Cicero (106—43 B.C.E.)

Marcus Tullius Cicero was born on January 3, 106 B.C.E. and was murdered on December 7, 43 B.C.E. His life coincided with the decline and fall of the Roman Republic, and he was an important actor in many of the significant political events of his time, and his writings are now a valuable source of information to us about those events. He was, among other things, an orator, lawyer, politician, and philosopher. Making sense of his writings and understanding his philosophy requires us to keep that in mind. He placed politics above philosophical study; the latter was valuable in its own right but was even more valuable as the means to more effective political action. The only periods of his life in which he wrote philosophical works were the times he was forcibly prevented from taking part in politics.

While Cicero is currently not considered an exceptional thinker, largely on the (incorrect) grounds that his philosophy is derivative and unoriginal, in previous centuries he was considered one of the great philosophers of the ancient era, and he was widely read well into the 19th century. Probably the most notable example of his influence is St. Augustine’s claim that it was Cicero’s Hortensius (an exhortation to philosophy, the text of which is unfortunately lost) that turned him away from his sinful life and towards philosophy and ultimately to God. Augustine later adopted Cicero’s definition of a commonwealth and used it in his argument that Christianity was not responsible for the destruction of Rome by the barbarians.

Table of Contents

1. Cicero’s life
2. Cicero’s influence
3. Cicero’s thought
4. Cicero and the Academic Skeptics
5. Cicero and Stoicism and Peripateticism
6. Cicero and Epicureanism
7. Cicero’s writings
   1. On Invention
   2. On the Orator
   3. On the Republic
   4. On the Laws
   5. Brutus
   6. Stoic Paradoxes
   7. The Orator
   8. Consolation
   9. Hortensius
   10. Academics
   11. On Ends
   12. Tusculan Disputations
   13. On the Nature of the Gods
   14. On Divination
   15. On Fate
   16. On Old Age
   17. On Friendship
   18. Topics
   19. On Duties
8. Further reading on Cicero’s life
9. Further reading on Cicero’s philosophy
   1. Texts by Cicero
   2. Texts about Cicero

1. Cicero’s life

Cicero’s political career was a remarkable one. At the time, high political offices in Rome, though technically achieved by winning elections, were almost exclusively controlled by a group of wealthy aristocratic families that had held them for many generations. Cicero’s family, though aristocratic, was not one of them, nor did it have great wealth. But Cicero had a great deal of political ambition; at a very young age he chose as his motto the same one Achilles was said to have had: to always be the best and overtop the rest. Lacking the advantages of a proper ancestry, there were essentially only two career options open to him. One was a military career, since military success was thought to result from exceptional personal qualities and could lead to popularity and therefore political opportunity (as was the case much later for American presidents Ulysses S. Grant and Dwight D. Eisenhower). Cicero, however, was no soldier. He hated war, and served in the military only very briefly as a young man.

Instead, Cicero chose a career in the law. To prepare for this career, he studied jurisprudence, rhetoric, and philosophy. When he felt he was ready, he began taking part in legal cases. A career in the law could lead to political success for several reasons, all of which are still relevant today. First, a lawyer would gain a great deal of experience in making speeches. Second, he (there were no female lawyers in Rome) could also gain exposure and popularity from high-profile cases. Finally, a successful lawyer would build up a network of political connections, which is important now but was even more important in Cicero’s time, when political competition was not conducted along party lines or on the basis of ideology, but instead was based on loose, shifting networks of personal friendships and commitments. Cicero proved to be an excellent orator and lawyer, and a shrewd politician. He was elected to each of the principal Roman offices (quaestor, aedile, praetor, and consul) on his first try and at the earliest age at which he was legally allowed to run for them. Having held office made him a member of the Roman Senate. This body had no formal authority — it could only offer advice — but its advice was almost always followed. He was, as can be imagined, very proud of his successes. (Though this is not the place for a long discussion of Roman government, it should be noted that the Roman republic was not a democracy. It was really more of an oligarchy than anything else, with a few men wielding almost all economic and political power).

During his term as consul (the highest Roman office) in 63 B.C.E. he was responsible for unraveling and exposing the conspiracy of Catiline, which aimed at taking over the Roman state by force, and five of the conspirators were put to death without trial on Cicero’s orders. Cicero was proud of this too, claiming that he had singlehandedly saved the commonwealth; many of his contemporaries and many later commentators have suggested that he exaggerated the magnitude of his success. But there can be little doubt that Cicero enjoyed widespread popularity at this time – though his policy regarding the Catilinarian conspirators had also made him enemies, and the executions without trial gave them an opening.

The next few years were very turbulent, and in 60 B.C.E. Julius Caesar, Pompey, and Crassus (often referred to today as the First Triumvirate) combined their resources and took control of Roman politics. Recognizing his popularity and talents, they made several attempts to get Cicero to join them, but Cicero hesitated and eventually refused, preferring to remain loyal to the Senate and the idea of the Republic. This left him open to attacks by his enemies, and in January of 58 B.C.E. one of them, the tribune Clodius (a follower of Caesar’s), proposed a law to be applied retroactively stating that anyone who killed a Roman citizen without trial would be stripped of their citizenship and forced into exile. This proposal led to rioting and physical attacks on Cicero, who fled the city. The law passed. Cicero was forbidden to live within 500 miles of Italy, and all his property was confiscated. This exile, during which Cicero could not take part in politics, provided the time for his first period of sustained philosophical study as an adult. After roughly a year and a half of exile, the political conditions changed, his property was restored to him, and he was allowed to return to Rome, which he did to great popular approval, claiming that the Republic was restored with him. This was also treated by many as an absurd exaggeration.

Cicero owed a debt to the triumvirate for ending his exile (and for not killing him), and for the next eight years he repaid that debt as a lawyer. Because he still could not engage in politics, he also had time to continue his studies of philosophy, and between 55 and 51 he wrote On the Orator, On the Republic, and On the Laws. The triumvirate, inherently unstable, collapsed with the death of Crassus and in 49 B.C.E. Caesar crossed the Rubicon River, entering Italy with his army and igniting a civil war between himself and Pompey (Caesar’s own account of this war still survives). Cicero was on Pompey’s side, though halfheartedly. He felt that at this point the question was not whether Rome would be a republic or an empire but whether Pompey or Caesar would be Emperor, and he believed that it would make little difference, for it would be a disaster in either case. Caesar and his forces won in 48 B.C.E., and Caesar became the first Roman emperor. He gave Cicero a pardon and allowed him to return to Rome in July of 47 B.C.E., but Cicero was forced to stay out of politics. Most of the rest of his life was devoted to studying and writing about philosophy, and he produced the rest of his philosophical writings during this time.

Caesar was murdered by a group of senators on the Ides of March in 44 B.C.E. Cicero was a witness to the murder, though he was not a part of the conspiracy. The murder led to another power struggle in which Mark Antony (of “Antony and Cleopatra” fame), Marcus Lepidus, and Octavian (later called Augustus) were the key players. It also gave Cicero, who still hoped that the Republic could be restored, the opportunity for what is considered his finest hour as a politician. With Caesar dead, the Senate once again mattered, and it was to the Senate that Cicero made the series of speeches known as the Philippics (named after the speeches the Greek orator Demosthenes made to rouse the Athenians to fight Philip of Macedon). These speeches called for the Senate to aid Octavian in overcoming Antony (Cicero believed that Octavian, still a teenager, would prove to be a useful tool who could be discarded by the Senate once his purpose was served).

However, Antony, Lepidus, and Octavian were able to come to terms and agreed to share power. Each of them had enemies that he wanted eliminated, and as part of the power-sharing deal each got to eliminate those enemies. Antony put not only Cicero but also his son, his brother, and his nephew on the list of those to be killed (the Philippics are not very nice to him at all, especially the Second Philippic). Though Octavian owed his success in part to Cicero, he chose not to extend his protection to Cicero and his family. Cicero, his brother, and his nephew tried somewhat belatedly to flee Italy. His brother and nephew turned aside to collect more money for the trip, and were killed. Cicero kept going. Plutarch describes the end of Cicero’s life: “Cicero heard [his pursuers] coming and ordered his servants to set the litter [in which he was being carried] down where they were. He…looked steadfastly at his murderers. He was all covered in dust; his hair was long and disordered, and his face was pinched and wasted with his anxieties – so that most of those who stood by covered their faces while Herennius was killing him. His throat was cut as he stretched his neck out from the litter….By Antony’s orders Herennius cut off his head and his hands.” Antony then had Cicero’s head and hands nailed to the speaker’s podium in the Senate as a warning to others. Cicero’s son, also named Marcus, who was in Greece at this time, was not executed. He became consul in 30 B.C.E. under Octavian, who had defeated Antony after the Second Triumvirate collapsed. As consul, the younger Marcus got to announce Antony’s suicide to the Senate. It is unfortunate that we have no record of this speech.

2. Cicero’s influence

While Cicero is currently not considered an exceptional thinker, largely on the (incorrect) grounds that his philosophy is derivative and unoriginal, in previous centuries he was considered one of the great philosophers of the ancient era, and he was widely read well into the 19th century. Probably the most notable example of his influence is St. Augustine’s claim that it was Cicero’s Hortensius (an exhortation to philosophy, the text of which is unfortunately lost) that turned him away from his sinful life and towards philosophy and ultimately to God. Augustine later adopted Cicero’s definition of a commonwealth and used it in his argument that Christianity was not responsible for the destruction of Rome by the barbarians. Further discussion of Cicero’s influence on later philosophers can be found in MacKendrick, Chapter 20 and Appendix.

3. Cicero’s thought

Cicero subordinated philosophy to politics, so it should not surprise us to discover that his philosophy had a political purpose: the defense, and if possible the improvement, of the Roman Republic. The politicians of his time, he believed, were corrupt and no longer possessed the virtuous character that had been the main attribute of Romans in the earlier days of Roman history. This loss of virtue was, he believed, the cause of the Republic’s difficulties. He hoped that the leaders of Rome, especially in the Senate, would listen to his pleas to renew the Republic. This could only happen if the Roman elite chose to improve their characters and place commitments to individual virtue and social stability ahead of their desires for fame, wealth, and power. Having done this, the elite would enact legislation that would force others to adhere to similar standards, and the Republic would flourish once again. Whether this belief shows an admirable commitment to the principles of virtue and nobility or a blindness to the nature of the exceedingly turbulent and violent politics of his time, or perhaps both, is impossible to say with certainty.

Cicero, therefore, tried to use philosophy to bring about his political goals. Like most intellectual endeavors in Cicero’s time, philosophy was an activity in which Greece (and especially Athens) still held the lead. The Romans were more interested in practical matters of law, governance, and military strategy than they were in philosophy and art (many of Cicero’s writings include justifications for his study of philosophy and arguments that it ought to be taken seriously). But for Cicero to really use philosophy effectively, he needed to make it accessible to a Roman audience. He did this in part by translating Greek works into Latin, including inventing Latin words where none seemed suitable for Greek concepts (including the Latin words which give us the English words morals, property, individual, science, image, and appetite), and in part by drawing on and idealizing Roman history to provide examples of appropriate conduct and to illustrate the arguments of philosophy. He also summarized in Latin many of the beliefs of the primary Greek philosophical schools of the time (and he is the source of much of our knowledge about these schools). These included the Academic Skeptics, >Peripatetics, Stoics, and Epicureans. Cicero was well acquainted with all these schools, and had teachers in each of them at different times of his life. But he professed allegiance throughout his life to the Academy.

4. Cicero and the Academic Skeptics

In Cicero’s time there were in fact two schools claiming to be descended from the First Academy, established by Plato. Cicero studied briefly in both the Old Academy and the New Academy; the differences between the two need not concern us. What they shared was their basic commitment to skepticism: a belief that human beings cannot be certain in their knowledge about the world, and therefore no philosophy can be said to be true. The Academic Skeptics offered little in the way of positive argument themselves; they mostly criticized the arguments of others.

This can be annoying, but it requires real mental abilities, including the ability to see all sides of an issue and to understand and accept that any belief, no matter how cherished, is only provisional and subject to change later if a better argument presents itself. It is the approach which underlies the modern scientific method, though the Academics did not use it in that way. Even something like evolution, for which there is mountains of evidence and seemingly no resonable alternative, is treated as a theory subject to change if needed rather than an eternal truth.

And it is this approach which Cicero embraced. This is not surprising if we consider again why he was interested in philosophy in the first place. As a lawyer, he would need to see as many sides of an argument as possible in order to argue his clients’ cases effectively. He would have to marshal all the available evidence in a methodical way, so as to make the strongest possible case, and he would have to accept that he might at any time have to deal with new evidence or new issues, forcing him to totally reconsider his strategies. As a politician, he would need a similar grasp of the issues and a similar degree of flexibility in order to speak and to act effectively. A lawyer or politician who fanatically sticks to a particular point of view and cannot change is not likely to be successful. Adopting the teachings of the Academy also allowed Cicero to pick and choose whatever he wanted from the other philosophical schools, and he claims to do this at various points in his writings. Finally, his allegiance to the Academy helps to explain his use of the dialogue form: it enables Cicero to put a number of arguments in the mouths of others without having to endorse any particular position himself.

However, Cicero did not consistently write as a member of the Academy. Skepticism can, if taken to extremes, lead to complete inaction (if we can’t be certain of the correctness of our decisions or of our actions, why do anything at all?) which was incompatible with Cicero’s commitment to political activity. Even if it isn’t taken that far, it can still be dangerous. It may not be a problem if trained, knowledgeable philosophers are skeptical about things like whether the gods exist or whether the laws are just. But if people in general are skeptical about these things, they may end up behaving lawlessly and immorally (see Aristophanes’ Clouds for a portrayal of this). Thus, while Cicero is willing to accept Academic Skepticism in some areas, he is not willing to do so when it comes to ethics and politics. For doctrines in these areas, he turns to the Stoics and Peripatetics.

5. Cicero and Stoicism and Peripateticism

Cicero believed that these two schools taught essentially the same things, and that the difference between them was whether virtue was the only thing human beings should pursue or whether it was merely the best thing to be pursued. According to the first view, things like money and health have no value; according to the second, they have value but nowhere near enough to justify turning away from virtue to attain them. This was a difference with little practical consequence, so far as Cicero was concerned, and there is no need to take it up here.

Since, according to the teachings of the Academy, Cicero was free to accept any argument that he found convincing, he could readily make use of Stoic teachings, and he did so particularly when discussing politics and ethics. In the Laws, for example, he explicitly says that he is setting aside his skepticism, for it is dangerous if people do not believe unhesitatingly in the sanctity of the laws and of justice. Thus he will rely on Stoicism instead. He puts forth Stoic doctrines not dogmatically, as absolutely and always true, but as the best set of beliefs so far developed. We ought to adhere to them because our lives, both individually and collectively, will be better if we do. It is essentially Stoic ethical teachings that Cicero urges the Roman elite to adopt.

Stoicism as Cicero understood it held that the gods existed and loved human beings. Both during and after a person’s life, the gods rewarded or punished human beings according to their conduct in life. The gods had also provided human beings with the gift of reason. Since humans have this in common with the gods, but animals share our love of pleasure, the Stoics argued, as Socrates had, that the best, most virtuous, and most divine life was one lived according to reason, not according to the search for pleasure. This did not mean that humans had to shun pleasure, only that it must be enjoyed in the right way. For example, it was fine to enjoy sex, but not with another man’s wife. It was fine to enjoy wine, but not to the point of shameful drunkenness. Finally, the Stoics believed that human beings were all meant to follow natural law, which arises from reason. The natural law is also the source of all properly made human laws and communities. Because human beings share reason and the natural law, humanity as a whole can be thought of as a kind of community, and because each of us is part of a group of human beings with shared human laws, each of us is also part of a political community. This being the case, we have duties to each of these communities, and the Stoics recognized an obligation to take part in politics (so far as is possible) in order to discharge those duties. The Stoic enters politics not for public approval, wealth, or power (which are meaningless) but in order to improve the communities of which they are a part. If politics is painful, as it would often prove to be for Cicero, that’s not important. What matters is that the virtuous life requires it.

6. Cicero and Epicureanism

For the Epicurean philosophy Cicero had only disdain throughout most of his life, though his best friend Atticus was an Epicurean. This disdain leads him to seriously misrepresent its teachings as being based on the shameless pursuit of base pleasures, such as food, sex, and wine (the modern day equivalent being sex, drugs, and rock’n’roll). However, this is not what Epicurus, who founded the school, or his later followers actually taught. Epicurus did claim that nature teaches us that pleasure is the only human good, and that life should therefore be guided by the pursuit of pleasure. But he meant by pleasure the absence of pain, including the pain caused by desires for wealth, fame, or power. This did not mean living life as one long Bacchanalia. Instead it meant withdrawing from politics and public life and living quietly with friends, engaged in the study of philosophy, which provided the highest pleasure possible (think of a monastery without the Bible and the rigorous discipline). The notion that the life of philosophy is the most pleasant life, of course, also comes from Socrates. Epicureans were also publicly atheists. Their atheism was based on a theory of atomism, which they were the first to propose. Everything in the universe, they argued, was made up of atoms, including the heavenly bodies; the gods did not exist. This knowledge was not a cause of despair but a cause of joy, they believed, since one of the greatest human pains is the pain caused by the fear of death and what lies beyond it. According to the Epicureans, death simply meant the end of sensation, as one’s atoms came apart. Thus there was no reason to fear it, because there was no divine judgment or afterlife. The best known Epicurean is Lucretius, a contemporary of Cicero’s at Rome who Cicero may have known personally. Lucretius’ On the Nature of Things, available online, sets out Epicurean teachings.

It is easy to see why Cicero, a man deeply involved in politics and the pursuit of glory, would find any doctrine that advocated the rejection of public life repulsive. It is also easy to see why someone concerned with the reform of character and conduct would reject public atheism, since fear of divine punishment often prevents people from acting immorally. During his forced exile from politics at the end of his life, however, some of his letters claim that he has gone over to Epicureanism, presumably for the reasons he hated it previously. No longer able to take part in public life, the best he could hope for was the cultivation of private life and the pleasures that it had to offer. Since Cicero abandoned this idea as soon as the opportunity to return to public life arose, there is no reason to take his professed conversion seriously – unless we wish to see in it an example of changing his beliefs to reflect changing circumstances, and thus an example of his commitment to the Academy.

7. Cicero’s writings

Cicero’s written work can be sorted into three categories. None can be said to represent the “true” Cicero, and all of Cicero’s work, we must remember, has a political purpose. This does not make it worthless as philosophy, but it should make us cautious about proclaiming anything in particular to be what Cicero “really thought.” Also, as an Academic skeptic, Cicero felt free to change his mind about something when a better position presented itself, and this makes it even more difficult to bring his writing together into a coherent whole.

The first category of Cicero’s work is his philosophic writings, many of which were patterned after Plato’s or Aristotle’s dialogues. These writings, in chronological order, include On Invention, On the Orator, On the Republic, On the Laws, Brutus, Stoic Paradoxes, The Orator, Consolation, Hortensius, Academics, On Ends, Tusculan Disputations, On the Nature of the Gods, On Divination, On Fate, On Old Age, On Friendship, Topics, On Glory, and On Duties. Unfortunately, several of them have been lost almost entirely (Hortensius, on the value of philosophy, the Consolation, which Cicero wrote to himself on the death of his beloved daughter Tullia in order to overcome his grief, and On Glory, almost totally lost) and several of the others are available only in fragmentary condition (notably the Laws, which Cicero may never have finished, and the Republic, fragments of which were only discovered in 1820 in the Vatican). These will be discussed in more detail below. While each of them is dedicated and addressed to a particular individual or two, they were intended to be read by a wide audience, and even at the end of his life Cicero never gave up entirely on the hope that the Republic and his influence would be restored. Hence these are not purely philosophical writings, but were designed with a political purpose in mind, and we are entitled to wonder whether Cicero is being entirely candid in the opinions that he expresses. Also, the dialogue form is useful for an author who wishes to express a number of opinions without having to endorse one. As we have seen, Cicero’s skepticism would have made this an especially attractive style. We should not assume too quickly that a particular character speaks for Cicero. Instead we should assume that, unless he explicitly says otherwise, Cicero wanted all the viewpoints presented to be considered seriously, even if some or all of them have weaknesses.

The second category is the speeches Cicero made as a lawyer and as a Senator, about 60 of which remain. These speeches provide many insights into Roman cultural, political, social, and intellectual life, as well as glimpses of Cicero’s philosophy. Many of them also describe the corruption and immorality of the Roman elite. However, they have to be taken with a grain of salt, because Cicero was writing and delivering them in order to achieve some legal outcome and/or political goal and by his own admission was not above saying misleading or inaccurate things if he thought they would be effective. In addition, the speeches that we have are not verbatim recordings of what Cicero actually said, but are versions that he polished later for publication (the modern American analogy would be to the Congressional Record, which allows members of Congress the opportunity to revise the text of their speeches before they are published in the Record). In some cases (such as the Second Philippic) the speech was never delivered at all, but was merely published in written form, again with some political goal in mind.

Finally, roughly 900 letters to and from (mostly from) Cicero have been preserved. Most of them were addressed to his close friend Atticus or his brother Quintius, but some correspondence to and from some other Romans including famous Romans such as Caesar has also been preserved. The letters often make an interesting contrast to the philosophic dialogues, as they deal for the most part not with lofty philosophical matters but with the mundane calculations, compromises, flatteries, and manipulations that were part of politics in Rome and which would be familiar to any politician today. It is important to be cautious in drawing conclusions from them about Cicero’s “true” beliefs since they rely on an understanding between the sender and recipient not available to others, because they are often not the result of full reflection or an attempt at complete clarity and precision (after all, a friend can be counted on to know what you mean), and because many of them, like the speeches, were written with a political purpose in mind that may make them less than fully truthful and straightforward.

Space does not allow us to discuss Cicero’s speeches and letters. The serious student of Cicero, however, will not want to ignore them. What follows is a brief summary of the main points each of Cicero’s philosophical works.

a. On Invention

Written while Cicero was still a teenager, it is a handbook on oratory. Cicero later dismissed it and argued that his other oratorical works had superceded it.

b. On the Orator

A lengthy treatise, in the form of a dialogue, on the ideal orator. While it is full of detail which can be tedious to those who are not deeply interested in the theory of rhetoric, it also contains useful discussions of the nature of and the relationships among law, philosophy, and rhetoric. Cicero places rhetoric above both law and philosophy, arguing that the ideal orator would have mastered both law and philosophy (including natural philosophy) and would add eloquence besides. He argues that in the old days philosophy and rhetoric were taught together, and that it is unfortunate that they have now been separated. The best orator would also be the best human being, who would understand the correct way to live, act upon it by taking a leading role in politics, and instruct others in it through speeches, through the example of his life, and through making good laws.

c. On the Republic

This dialogue is, unfortunately, in an extremely mutilated condition. It describes the ideal commonwealth, such as might be brought about by the orator described in On the Orator. In doing so it tries to provide philosophical underpinnings for existing Roman institutions and to demonstrate that Roman history has been essentially the increasing perfection of the Republic, which is superior to any other government because it is a mixed government. By this Cicero means that it combines elements of monarchy, aristocracy, and democracy in the right balance; the contemporary reader may well disagree. But even this government can be destroyed and is being destroyed by the moral decay of the aristocracy. Thus Cicero describes the importance of an active life of virtue, the foundations of community, including the community of all human beings, the role of the statesman, and the concept of natural law. It also includes the famous Dream of Scipio.

d. On the Laws

This dialogue is also badly mutilated, and may never have been finished. In it Cicero lays out the laws that would be followed in the ideal commonwealth described in On the Republic. Finding the source of law and justice, he says, requires explaining “what nature has given to humans; what a quantity of wonderful things the human mind embraces; for the sake of performing and fulfilling what function we are born and brought into the world; what serves to unite people; and what natural bond there is between them.” Philosophy teaches us that by nature human beings have reason, that reason enables us to discover the principles of justice, and that justice gives us law. Therefore any valid law is rooted in nature, and any law not rooted in nature (such as a law made by a tyrant) is no law at all. The gods also share in reason, and because of this they can be said to be part of a community with humanity. They care for us, and punish and reward us as appropriate. Much of what remains of this dialogue is devoted to religious law.

e. Brutus

This dialogue too is in a mutilated condition. It is a history of oratory in Greece and Rome, listing hundreds of orators and their distinguishing characteristics, weaknesses as well as strengths. There is also some discussion of oratory in the abstract. Cicero says that the orator must “instruct his listener, give him pleasure, [and] stir his emotions,” and, as in On the Orator, that the true orator needs to have instruction in philosophy, history, and law. Such a person will have the tools necessary to become a leader of the commonwealth. This dialogue is less inclined to the argument that the orator must be a good man; for example, Cicero says that orators must be allowed to “distort history [i.e. lie] in order to give more point to their narrative.”

f. Stoic Paradoxes

Not a dialogue; Cicero lays out six Stoic principles (called paradoxes) which the average listener would not be likely to agree with and tries to make them both understandable and persuasive to such a listener. It is, he says, an exercise in turning the specialized jargon of the Stoics into plain speech for his own amusement (which obviously does not require Cicero to actually agree with any of the Stoic beliefs). The beliefs discussed are as follows: moral worth is the only good; virtue is sufficient for happiness; all sins and virtues are equal; every fool is insane; only the wise man is really free; only the wise man is really rich. These topics are largely taken up again in the Tusculan Disputations. MacKendrick argues strenuously that this work is far more than an idle amusement, and that it showcases Cicero’s rhetorical skills as well as being an attack on his enemies.

g. The Orator

Written in the form of a letter on the topic of the perfect orator, it includes a defense of Cicero’s own oratorical style (Cicero was never known for his modesty). It emphasizes that the orator must be able to prove things to the audience, please them, and sway their emotions. It also includes the famous quote “To be ignorant of what occurred before you were born is to remain always a child.”

h. Consolation

This text is lost except for fragments cited by other authors. Cicero wrote it to diminish his grief over the death of his daughter Tullia through the use of philosophy. From his letters we know that it was not entirely successful.

i. Hortensius

his text is heavily fragmented and we can determine little more than its broad outline. It is written in order to praise philosophy, which alone can bring true happiness through the development of reason and the overcoming of passions. In antiquity it was widely read and very popular; it was instrumental in converting St. Augustine to Christianity.

j. Academics

The positions of the various philosophical schools on epistemology (how we can perceive and understand the world) and the possibility of knowing truth are set out and refuted by the participants in this dialogue (of which we have different parts of two editions). Cicero also incorporates a detailed history of the development of these schools following the death of Socrates (diagrammed nicely in MacKendrick; see below). The nature of Cicero’s own skepticism can be found in this work; the reader is left to choose the argument that is most persuasive.

k. On Ends

A dialogue which sets out the case, pro and con, of the several philosophic schools on the question of the end or purpose (what Aristotle called the telos) of human life. For Cicero, and arguably for ancient philosophy generally, this was the most important question: “What is the end, the final and ultimate aim, which gives the standard for all principles of right living and of good conduct?” Today many are inclined to believe that an answer to this question, if an answer exists at all, must be found in religion, but Cicero held that it was a question for philosophy, and this text was meant to popularize among the Romans the various answers that were being offered at the time. As with Academics, the reader must decide which case is most persuasive.

l. Tusculan Disputations

Another attempt to popularize philosophy at Rome and demonstrate that the Romans and their language had the potential to achieve the very highest levels of philosophy. The first book presents the argument that death is an evil; this argument is then refuted. The second book presents and refutes the argument that pain is an evil. The third book argues that the wise man will not suffer from anxiety and fear. In the fourth book Cicero demonstrates that the wise man does not suffer from excessive joy or lust. And in the fifth and final book Cicero argues that virtue, found through philosophy, is sufficient for a happy life. These positions are all compatible with Stoicism.

m. On the Nature of the Gods

This dialogue, along with the next two, was intended by Cicero to form a trilogy on religious questions. It offers desciptions of literally dozens of varieties of religion. Emphasis is especially placed on the Epicurean view (the gods exist but are indifferent about human beings), which is described and then refuted, and the Stoic view (the gods govern the world, love human beings, and after death reward the good and punish the bad), which is similarly stated and refuted. At the end of the dialogue the characters have not reached agreement. This is perhaps the dialogue that best illustrates Cicero’s skeptical method.

n. On Divination

This dialogue too, according to Cicero, is meant to set out arguments both for and against a topic, in this case the validity of divination (predicting the future through methods such as astrology, reading animal entrails, watching the flight of birds, etc.) without asserting that either side is correct. The case for the validity of divination is presented in the first book and then crushed in the second (in which Cicero himself is the main speaker). While Cicero explicitly says that he reserves judgment, it is hard to conclude that Cicero approved of divination, which he saw as drawing on superstition rather than religion. Religion was useful because it helped to control human behavior and could be used as a tool for public policy; and in this context divination could be useful too (as when an unwise political decision was prevented by the announcement that the omens were unfavorable).

o. On Fate

The text is fragmented. The topic discussed is whether or not human beings can be said to have free will, so much of the book deals with theories of causation and the meaning of truth and falsehood. Cicero apparently rejects the idea that fate determines all our actions and argues that human beings, to a significant extent, have free will.

p. On Old Age

In this dialogue, we learn that the sufferings of old age do not affect everyone equally but in fact are dependent on character; old men of good character continue to enjoy life, though in different ways than in their youth, while men of bad character have new miseries added to their previous ones. Nothing is more natural than to age and die, and if we are to live in accordance with nature (a Stoic teaching) we should face death calmly. If one has lived well, there are many pleasant memories to enjoy, as well as prestige and the intellectual pleasures that are highest of all.

q. On Friendship

This dialogue describes the nature of true friendship, which is possible only between good men, who are virtuous and follow nature. This friendship is based on virtue, and while it offers material advantages it does not aim at them or even seek them. The dialogue goes on to describe the bonds of friendship among lesser men, which are stronger the more closely they are related but which exist even in more distant relationships. The conclusion is reached that all human beings are bonded together, along with the gods, in a community made up of the cosmos as a whole and based on shared reason. There is, however, awareness of the fact that in the real world friendship can be a difficult thing to maintain due to political pressures and adversity. It also includes the assertion that Cato was better than Socrates because he is praised for deeds, not words, which is perhaps the center of Cicero’s personal philosophy (recall that he only wrote about philosophy, rhetoric and so on when political participation was denied to him by force), as well as the claim that love is not compatible with fear – a claim that Machiavelli found significant enough to explicitly reject in The Prince.

r. Topics

A toolkit for orators on the science of argument, touching on the law, rhetoric, and philosophy, and setting out the various kinds of arguments available to the orator, rules of logic, and the kinds of questions he may find himself facing. It has similarities to Aristotle’s Topics and part of his Rhetoric.

s. On Duties

Written in the form of a letter to his son Marcus, then in his late teens and studying philosophy in Athens (though, we can gather from the letters, not studying it all that seriously), but intended from the start to reach a wider audience. Cicero addresses the topic of duty (including both the final purpose of life, which defines our duties, and the way in which duties should be performed), and says that he will follow the Stoics in this area, but only as his judgment requires. More explicitly, the letter discusses how to determine what is honorable, and which of two honorable things is more honorable; how to determine what is expedient and how to judge between two expedient things; and what to do when the honorable and the expedient seem to conflict. Cicero asserts that they can only seem to conflict; in reality they never do, and if they seem to it simply shows that we do not understand the situation properly. The honorable action is the expedient and vice-versa. The bonds among all human beings are described, and young Marcus is urged to follow nature and wisdom, along with whatever political activity might still be possible, rather than seeking pleasure and indolence. On Duties, written at the end of Cicero’s life, in his own name, for the use of his son, pulls together a wide range of material, and is probably the best starting place for someone wanting to get acquainted with Cicero’s philosophic works.

8. Further reading on Cicero’s life

Plutarch’s “Life of Cicero” is the source of much of our knowledge of Cicero’s life. It should be kept in mind that Plutarch is writing a century after Cicero’s death and has no firsthand knowledge of the events he describes. He also writes to offer moral lessons, rather than simply record events. The Roman historian Sallust’s Conspiracy of Catiline offers a description of that conspiracy, written twenty years after it took place, which fails to give Cicero the same degree of importance he gave himself. Both of these texts are available online and in inexpensive Penguin editions. D.R. Shackleton Bailey, Cicero, incorporates many of Cicero’s own letters in describing Cicero and the events of his life; the reader gets a firsthand look at events and a taste of Cicero’s enjoyable prose style through these letters. Manfred Fuhrmann, Cicero and the Roman Republic, uses the same approach and also includes material from speeches and the philosophical writings. Christian Habicht, Cicero the Politician, is a short (99 pages of text) history of Cicero’s life and times. Its brevity makes it a useful starting point and overview. Even shorter (84 pages of text) is Thomas Wiedemann, Cicero and the End of the Roman Republic. Weidemann even finds room for photographs and drawings, which makes this book perhaps too short. R.E. Smith, Cicero the Statesman, focuses on the period from 71 B.C.E.-43 B.C.E., which is the most active part of Cicero’s life. He gives a very clear exposition of Roman politics as well as Cicero’s part in it. Thomas Mitchell’s two volumes, Cicero, the Ascending Years (which covers Cicero’s life up to the end of his consulship) and Cicero the Senior Statesman (which covers the years from the end of his consulship to his death), in his words, aim to “provide a detailed and fully documented account of Cicero’s political life that combines the story of his career with a comprehensive discussion of the political ideas and events that helped shape it.” He succeeds admirably. There are also available a large number of general histories of the Roman Republic and empire which the reader is encouraged to explore.

9. Further reading on Cicero’s philosophy

a. Texts by Cicero

The standard versions of Cicero’s writings in English are still the Loeb editions of the Harvard University Press. They include the Latin text on the left hand pages and the English translation on the right hand pages, which is obviously of particular use to one who knows or is learning Latin. There are Loeb editions of all of Cicero’s speeches, letters, and philosophical writings known to exist, and they were the main sources for this article. The Perseus Project includes Cicero’s writings in its online archives. The series of Cambridge Texts in the History of Political Thought has recently added editions of On the Commonwealth and On the Laws (in one volume, edited by James E.G. Zetzel) and On Duties (edited by M.T. Griffin and E.M. Atkins). These volumes include the Cambridge series’ usual excellent introductions and background material and were also helpful in preparing this article. The Oxford World’s Classics series has recently released a new translation of On the Commonwealth and On the Laws (edited by Jonathan Powell and Niall Rudd); while its supplemental material is not as thorough as that of the Cambridge edition, it is still worth reading.

b. Texts about Cicero

Perhaps the best starting point is Neal Wood, Cicero’s Social and Political Thought. It includes chapters on Cicero’s life and times and then discusses Cicero’s thought in a number of areas (for example there are chapters entitled “The Idea of the State” and “The Art of Politics”); admittedly its focus de-emphasizes Cicero’s thought on religion, oratorical theory, and so on. A wider range of essays, which can best be appreciated after reading Cicero’s texts, can be found in J.G.F. Powell, editor, Cicero the Philosopher: Twelve Papers. Andrew R. Dyck, A Commentary on Cicero, De Officiis (On Duty), is exactly what it says; it is massive (654 pages), detailed, relies on the reader’s knowing Latin, and is of interest almost exclusively to the specialist. Paul MacKendrick, The Philosophical Books of Cicero, offers detailed summaries of each of Cicero’s philosophical writings, as well as brief discussions which include the issue of Cicero’s sources and originality for each text (Cicero is defended against the charges of unoriginality commonly made against him). It was extremely helpful in the preparation of this article. The final two chapters, as mentioned above, trace Cicero’s influence down through the centuries and conclude with the observation that “Americans, though denied by their educational system a widespread knowledge of the classics in the original, share with Cicero a sturdy set of ethical values, which it is to be hoped they will, in true Ciceronian fashion, still cleave to in time of crisis.”

Author Information

Edward Clayton
Central Michigan University
U. S. A.

Epicurus (341—271 B.C.E.)

Epicurus is one of the major philosophers in the Hellenistic period, the three centuries following the death of Alexander the Great in 323 B.C.E. (and of Aristotle in 322 B.C.E.). Epicurus developed an unsparingly materialistic metaphysics, empiricist epistemology, and hedonistic ethics. Epicurus taught that the basic constituents of the world are atoms, uncuttable bits of matter, flying through empty space, and he tried to explain all natural phenomena in atomic terms. Epicurus rejected the existence of Platonic forms and an immaterial soul, and he said that the gods have no influence on our lives. Epicurus also thought skepticism was untenable, and that we could gain knowledge of the world relying upon the senses. He taught that the point of all one’s actions was to attain pleasure (conceived of as tranquility) for oneself, and that this could be done by limiting one’s desires and by banishing the fear of the gods and of death. Epicurus’ gospel of freedom from fear proved to be quite popular, and communities of Epicureans flourished for centuries after his death.

Table of Contents

1. Life
2. Sources
3. Metaphysics
   1. Arguments for the Existence of Atoms and Void
   2. Properties of Atoms, Limitlessness of the Universe
   3. Differences from Democritus
      1. Weight
      2. The Swerve
      3. Sensible Qualities
   4. Mechanistic Explanations of Natural Phenomena
   5. The Gods
   6. Philosophy of Mind
   7. Perception
4. Epistemology
   1. The Canon: Sensations, Preconceptions, and Feelings
   2. Anti-skeptical Arguments
      1. The “Lazy Argument”
      2. The Self-refutation Argument
      3. The Argument from Concept-formation
5. Ethics
   1. Hedonism, Psychological and Ethical
   2. Types of Pleasure
   3. Types of Desire
   4. The Virtues
   5. Justice
   6. Friendship
   7. Death
      1. The No Subject of Harm Argument
      2. The Symmetry Argument
6. References and Further Reading
   1. Collections of Primary Sources
   2. Recent Books on Particular Areas of Epicurus’ Philosophy

1. Life

Epicurus was born around 341 B.C.E., seven years after Plato’s death, and grew up in the Athenian colony of Samos, an island in the Mediterranean Sea. He was about 19 when Aristotle died, and he studied philosophy under followers of Democritus and Plato. Epicurus founded his first philosophical schools in Mytilene and Lampsacus, before moving to Athens around 306 B.C.E. There Epicurus founded the Garden, a combination of philosophical community and school. The residents of the Garden put Epicurus’ teachings into practice. Epicurus died from kidney stones around 271 or 270 B.C.E.

After Epicurus’ death, Epicureanism continued to flourish as a philosophical movement. Communities of Epicureans sprang up throughout the Hellenistic world; along with Stoicism, it was one of the major philosophical schools competing for people’s allegiances. Epicureanism went into decline with the rise of Christianity. Certain aspects of Epicurus’ thought were revived during the Renaissance and early modern periods, when reaction against scholastic neo-Aristotelianism led thinkers to turn to mechanistic explanations of natural phenomena.

2. Sources

Epicurus was a voluminous writer, but almost none of his own work survives. A likely reason for this is that Christian authorities found his ideas ungodly. Diogenes Laertius, who probably lived in the third century CE , wrote a 10-book Lives of the Philosophers, which includes three of Epicurus’ letters in its recounting of the life and teachings of Epicurus. These three letters are brief summaries of major areas of Epicurus’ philosophy: the Letter to Herodotus, which summarizes his metaphysics, the Letter to Pythocles, which gives atomic explanations for meteorological phenomena, and the Letter to Menoeceus, which summarizes his ethics. It also includes the Principal Doctrines, 40 sayings which deal mainly with ethical matters.

Because of the absence of Epicurus’ own writings, we have to rely on later writers to reconstruct Epicurus’ thought. Two of our most important sources are the Roman poet Lucretius (c. 94-55 B.C.E.) and the Roman politician Cicero (106-43 B.C.E.). Lucretius was an Epicurean who wrote De Rerum Natura (On the Nature of Things), a six-book poem expounding Epicurus’ metaphysics. Cicero was an adherent of the skeptical academy, who wrote a series of works setting forth the major philosophical systems of his day, including Epicureanism. Another major source is the essayist Plutarch (c. 50-120 CE), a Platonist. However, both Cicero and Plutarch were very hostile toward Epicureanism, so they must be used with care, since they often are less than charitable toward Epicurus, and may skew his views to serve their own purposes.

Although the major outlines of Epicurus’ thought are clear enough, the lack of sources means many of the details of his philosophy are still open to dispute.

3. Metaphysics

Epicurus believes that the basic constituents of the world are atoms (which are uncuttable, microscopic bits of matter) moving in the void (which is simply empty space). Ordinary objects are conglomerations of atoms. Furthermore, the properties of macroscopic bodies and all of the events we see occurring can be explained in terms of the collisions, reboundings, and entanglements of atoms.

a. Arguments for the Existence of Atoms and Void

Epicurus’ metaphysics starts from two simple points: (1) we see that there are bodies in motion, and (2) nothing comes into existence from what does not exist. Epicurus takes the first point to be simply a datum of experience. The second point is a commonplace of ancient Greek philosophy, derived from the Principle of Sufficient Reason (the principle that for everything which occurs there is a reason or explanation for why it occurs, and why this way rather than that).

First, because bodies move, there must be empty space for them to move in, and Epicurus calls this empty space ‘void.’ Second, the ordinary bodies that we see are compound bodies–that is, bodies which are made up of further bodies, which is shown by the fact that they can be broken down into smaller pieces. However, Epicurus thinks that this process of division cannot go on indefinitely, because otherwise bodies would dissolve away into nothing. Also, there must be basic and unchangeable building blocks of matter in order to explain the regularities in nature. These non-compound bodies are atoms–literally, ‘uncuttables.’ Only bodies and void exist per se, that is, exist without depending for their existence on something else. Other things–such as colors, time, and justice–are ultimately explicable as attributes of bodies.

b. Properties of Atoms, Limitlessness of the Universe

Because Epicurus believes that nothing comes into existence from nothing, he thinks that the universe has no beginning, but has always existed, and will always exist. Atoms, too, as the basic building blocks of all else, cannot come into existence, but have always existed. Our particular cosmos, however, is only a temporary agglomeration of atoms, and it is only one of an infinite number of such cosmoi, which come into existence and then dissolve away. Against Aristotle, Epicurus argues that the universe is unlimited in size. If the universe were limited in size, says Epicurus, you could go to the end of it, stick your fist out, and where your fist was located would be the new ‘limit’ of the universe. Of course, this process could be reiterated an endless number of times. Since the universe is unlimited in size, there must also be an unlimited number of atoms and an infinite amount of void. If the number of atoms were limited, then the ‘density’ of atoms in any region would effectively be zero, and there would be no macroscopic bodies, as there evidently are. And there must be an unlimited amount of void, since without a limitless amount of void, the infinite number of atoms would be unable to move.

c. Differences from Democritus

Up to this point, Epicurus is largely following the thought of Democritus, a pre-Socratic philosopher and one of the inventors of atomism. However, he modifies Democritus’ atomism in at least three important ways.

i. Weight

The first is that Epicurus thinks that atoms have weight. Like Democritus, Epicurus believes that atoms have the properties of size, shape, and resistance. Democritus explains all atomic motion as the result of previous atomic collisions, plus the inertia of atoms. Aristotle, however, criticizes Democritus on this point, saying that Democritus has not explained why it is that atoms move at all, rather than simply standing still. Epicurus seems to be answering this criticism when he says that atoms do have a natural motion of direction–‘downward’–even though there is no bottom to the universe. This natural motion is supposed to give an explanation for why atoms move in the first place. Also, Epicurus thinks that it is evident that bodies do tend to travel down, all else being equal, and he thinks that positing weight as an atomic property accounts for this better than thinking all atomic motion is the result of past collisions and inertia.

ii. The Swerve

The second modification of Democritus’ views is the addition of the ‘swerve.’ In addition to the regular tendency of atoms to move downward, Epicurus thinks that occasionally, and at random times, the atoms swerve to the side. One reason for this swerve is that it is needed to explain why there are atomic collisions. The natural tendency of atoms is to fall straight downward, at uniform velocity. If this were the only natural atomic motion, the atoms never would have collided with one another, forming macroscopic bodies. As Lucretius puts it, they would ‘fall downward, like drops of rain, through the deep void.’ The second reason for thinking that atoms swerve is that a random atomic motion is needed to preserve human freedom and ‘break the bonds of fate,’ as Lucretius says. If the laws of atomic motion are deterministic, then the past positions of the atoms in the universe, plus these laws, determine everything that will occur, including human action. Cicero reports that Epicurus worries that, if it has been true from eternity that, e.g., “Milo will wrestle tomorrow,” then presently deliberating about whether to make it true or false would be idle.

iii. Sensible Qualities

The third difference between Epicurus and Democritus has to do with their attitudes toward the reality of sensible properties. Democritus thinks that, in reality, only atoms and the void exist, and that sensible qualities such as sweetness, whiteness, and the like exist only ‘by convention.’ It is controversial exactly how to understand Democritus’ position, but most likely he is asserting that atoms themselves have no sensible qualities–they are simply extended bits of stuff. The sensible qualities that we think bodies have, like sweetness, are not really in the object at all, but are simply subjective states of the percipient’s awareness produced by the interaction of bodies with our sense-organs. This is shown, thinks Democritus, by the fact that the same body appears differently to different percipients depending on their bodily constitution, e.g., that a ‘white’ body appears yellow to somebody with jaundice, or that honey tastes bitter to an ill person. From this, Democritus derives skeptical conclusions. He is pessimistic about our ability to gain any knowledge about the world on the basis of our senses, since they systematically deceive us about the way the world is.

Epicurus wants to resist these pessimistic conclusions. He argues that properties like sweetness, whiteness, and such do not exist at the atomic level–individual atoms are not sweet or white–but that these properties are nonetheless real. These are properties of macroscopic bodies, but the possession of these properties by macroscopic bodies are explicable in terms of the properties of and relations amongst the individual atoms that make up bodies. Epicurus thinks that bodies have the capability to cause us to have certain types of experiences because of their atomic structure, and that such capabilities are real properties of the bodies. Similar considerations apply for properties like “being healthy,” “being deadly,” and “being enslaved.” They are real, but can only apply to groups of atoms (like people), not individual atoms. And these sorts of properties are also relational properties, not intrinsic ones. For example, cyanide is deadly–not deadly per se, but deadly for human beings (and perhaps for other types of organisms). Nonetheless, its deadliness for us is still a real property of the cyanide, albeit a relational one.

d. Mechanistic Explanations of Natural Phenomena

One important aspect of Epicurus’ philosophy is his desire to replace teleological (goal-based) explanations of natural phenomena with mechanistic ones. His main target is mythological explanations of meteorological occurrences and the like in terms of the will of the gods. Because Epicurus wishes to banish the fear of the gods, he insists that occurrences like earthquakes and lightning can be explained entirely in atomic terms and are not due to the will of the gods. Epicurus is also against the intrinsic teleology of philosophers like Aristotle. Teeth appear to be well-designed for the purpose of chewing. Aristotle thinks that this apparent purposiveness in nature cannot be eliminated, and that the functioning of the parts of organisms must be explained by appealing to how they contribute to the functioning of the organism as a whole. Other philosophers, such as the Stoics, took this apparent design as evidence for the intelligence and benevolence of God. Epicurus, however, following Empedocles, tries to explain away this apparent purposiveness in nature in a proto-Darwinian way, as the result of a process of natural selection.

e. The Gods

Because of its denial of divine providence, Epicureanism was often charged in antiquity with being a godless philosophy, although Epicurus and his followers denied the charge. The main upshot of Epicurean theology is certainly negative, however. Epicurus’ mechanistic explanations of natural phenomena are supposed to displace explanations that appeal to the will of the gods. In addition, Epicurus is one of the earliest philosophers we know of to have raised the Problem of Evil, arguing against the notion that the world is under the providential care of a loving deity by pointing out the manifold suffering in the world.

Despite this, Epicurus says that there are gods, but these gods are quite different from the popular conception of gods. We have a conception of the gods, says Epicurus, as supremely blessed and happy beings. Troubling oneself about the miseries of the world, or trying to administer the world, would be inconsistent with a life of tranquility, says Epicurus, so the gods have no concern for us. In fact, they are unaware of our existence, and live eternally in the intermundia, the space between the cosmoi. For Epicurus, the gods function mainly as ethical ideals, whose lives we can strive to emulate, but whose wrath we need not fear.

Ancient critics thought the Epicurean gods were a thin smoke-screen to hide Epicurus’ atheism, and difficulties with a literal interpretation of Epicurus’ sayings on the nature of the gods (for instance, it appears inconsistent with Epicurus’ atomic theory to hold that any compound body, even a god, could be immortal) have led some scholars to conjecture that Epicurus’ ‘gods’ are thought-constructs, and exist only in human minds as idealizations, i.e., the gods exist, but only as projections of what the most blessed life would be.

f. Philosophy of Mind

Epicurus is one of the first philosophers to put forward an Identity Theory of Mind. In modern versions of the identity theory, the mind is identified with the brain, and mental processes are identified with neural processes. Epicurus’ physiology is quite different; the mind is identified as an organ that resides in the chest, since the common Greek view was that the chest, not the head, is the seat of the emotions. However, the underlying idea is quite similar. (Note: not all commentators accept that Epicurus’ theory is actually an Identity Theory.)

The main point that Epicurus wants to establish is that the mind is something bodily. The mind must be a body, thinks Epicurus, because of its ability to interact with the body. The mind is affected by the body, as vision, drunkenness, and disease show. Likewise, the mind affects the body, as our ability to move our limbs when we want to and the physiological effects of emotional states show. Only bodies can interact with other bodies, so the mind must be a body. Epicurus says that the mind cannot be something incorporeal, as Plato thinks, since the only thing that is not a body is void, which is simply empty space and cannot act or be acted upon.

The mind, then, is an organ in the body, and mental processes are identified with atomic processes. The mind is composed of four different types of particles–fire, air, wind, and the “nameless element,” which surpasses the other particles in its fineness. Although Epicurus is reticent about the details, some features of the mind are accounted for in terms of the features of these atoms–for instance, the mind is able to be moved a great deal by the impact of an image (which is something quite flimsy), because of the smallness of the particles that make up the mind. The mind proper, which is primarily responsible for sensation and thought, is located in the chest, but Epicurus thinks that there is also a ‘spirit,’ spread throughout the rest of the body, which allows the mind to communicate with it. The mind and spirit play roles very similar to those of the central and peripheral nervous systems in modern theory.

One important result of Epicurus’ philosophy of mind is that death is annihilation. The mind is able to engage in the motions of sensation and thought only when it is housed in the body and the atoms that make it up are properly arranged. Upon death, says Epicurus, the container of the body shatters, and the atoms disperse in the air. The atoms are eternal, but the mind made up of these atoms is not, just as other compound bodies cease to exist when the atoms that make them up disperse.

g. Perception

Epicurus explains perception in terms of the interaction of atoms with the sense-organs. Objects continually throw off one-atom-thick layers, like the skin peeling off of an onion. These images, or “eidola,” fly through the air and bang into one’s eyes, from which one learns about the properties of the objects that threw off these eidola. This explains vision. Other senses are analyzed in similar terms; e.g., the soothing action of smooth atoms on the tongue causes the sensation of sweetness. As noted above, Epicurus maintains that such sensible qualities are real qualities of bodies.

4. Epistemology

a. The Canon: Sensations, Preconceptions, and Feelings

Epicurus’ epistemology is resolutely empiricist and anti-skeptical. All of our knowledge ultimately comes from the senses, thinks Epicurus, and we can trust the senses, when properly used. Epicurus’ epistemology was contained in his work the ‘Canon,’ or ‘measuring stick,’ which is lost, so many of the details of his views are unavailable to us.

Epicurus says that there are three criteria of truth: sensations, ‘preconceptions,’ and feelings. Sensations give us information about the external world, and we can test the judgments based upon sensations against further sensations; e.g., a provisional judgment that a tower is round, based upon sensation, can be tested against later sensations to be corroborated or disproved. Epicurus says that all sensations give us information about the world, but that sensation itself is never in error, since sensation is a purely passive, mechanical reception of images and the like by sense-organs, and the senses themselves do not make judgments ‘that’ the world is this way or that. Instead, error enters in when we make judgments about the world based upon the information received through the senses.

Epicurus thinks that, in order to make judgments about the world, or even to start any inquiry whatsoever, we must already be in possession of certain basic concepts, which stand in need of no further proof or definition, on pain of entering into an infinite regress. This concern is similar to the Paradox of Inquiry explored by Plato in the Meno, that one must already know about something in order to be able to inquire about it. However, instead of postulating that our immaterial souls had acquaintance with transcendent Forms in a pre-natal existence, as Plato does, Epicurus thinks that we have certain ‘preconceptions’–concepts such as ‘body,’ ‘person,’ ‘usefulness,’ and ‘truth’–which are formed in our (material) minds as the result of repeated sense-experiences of similar objects. Further ideas are formed by processes of analogy or similarity or by compounding these basic concepts. Thus, all ideas are ultimately formed on the basis of sense-experience.

Feelings of pleasure and pain form the basic criteria for what is to be sought and avoided.

b. Anti-skeptical Arguments

Epicurus is concerned to refute the skeptical tendencies of Democritus, whose metaphysics and theory of perception were similar to Epicurus’. At least three separate anti-skeptical arguments are given by Epicureans:

i. The “Lazy Argument”

Epicurus says that it is impossible to live as a skeptic. If a person really were to believe that he knows nothing, then he would have no reason to engage in one course of action instead of another. Thus, the consistent skeptic would engage in no action whatsoever, and would die.

ii. The Self-refutation Argument

If a skeptic claims that nothing can be known, then one should ask whether he knows that nothing can be known. If he says ‘yes,’ then he is contradicting himself. If he doesn’t say yes, then he isn’t making a claim, and we don’t need to listen to him.

iii. The Argument from Concept-formation

If the skeptic says that nothing can be known, or that we cannot know the truth, we can ask him where he gets his knowledge of concepts such as ‘knowledge’ and ‘truth.’ If the senses cannot be relied on, as the skeptic claims, then he is not entitled to use concepts such as ‘knowledge’ and ‘truth’ in formulating his thesis, since such concepts derive from the senses.

5. Ethics

Epicurus’ ethics is a form of egoistic hedonism; i.e., he says that the only thing that is intrinsically valuable is one’s own pleasure; anything else that has value is valuable merely as a means to securing pleasure for oneself. However, Epicurus has a sophisticated and idiosyncratic view of the nature of pleasure, which leads him to recommend a virtuous, moderately ascetic life as the best means to securing pleasure. This contrasts Epicurus strongly with the Cyrenaics, a group of ancient hedonists who better fit the stereotype of hedonists as recommending a policy of “eat, drink, and be merry.”

a. Hedonism, Psychological and Ethical

Epicurus’ ethics starts from the Aristotelian commonplace that the highest good is what is valued for its own sake, and not for the sake of anything else, and Epicurus agrees with Aristotle that happiness is the highest good. However, he disagrees with Aristotle by identifying happiness with pleasure. Epicurus gives two reasons for this. The main reason is that pleasure is the only thing that people do, as a matter of fact, value for its own sake; that is, Epicurus’ ethical hedonism is based upon his psychological hedonism. Everything we do, claims Epicurus, we do for the sake ultimately of gaining pleasure for ourselves. This is supposedly confirmed by observing the behavior of infants, who, it is claimed, instinctively pursue pleasure and shun pain. This is also true of adults, thinks Epicurus, but in adults it is more difficult to see that this is true, since adults have much more complicated beliefs about what will bring them pleasure. But the Epicureans did spend a great deal of energy trying to make plausible the contention that all activity, even apparently self-sacrificing activity or activity done solely for the sake of virtue or what is noble, is in fact directed toward obtaining pleasure for oneself.

The second proof, which fits in well with Epicurus’ empiricism, supposedly lies in one’s introspective experience. One immediately perceives that pleasure is good and that pain is bad, in the same way that one immediately perceives that fire is hot; no further argument is needed to show the goodness of pleasure or the badness of pain. (Of course, this does not establish Epicurus’ further contention that only pleasure is intrinsically valuable and only pain is intrinsically bad.)

Although all pleasures are good and all pains evil, Epicurus says that not all pleasures are choiceworthy or all pains to be avoided. Instead, one should calculate what is in one’s long-term self-interest, and forgo what will bring pleasure in the short-term if doing so will ultimately lead to greater pleasure in the long-term.

b. Types of Pleasure

For Epicurus, pleasure is tied closely to satisfying one’s desires. He distinguishes between two different types of pleasure: ‘moving’ pleasures and ‘static’ pleasures. ‘Moving’ pleasures occur when one is in the process of satisfying a desire, e.g., eating a hamburger when one is hungry. These pleasures involve an active titillation of the senses, and these feelings are what most people call ‘pleasure.’ However, Epicurus says that after one’s desires have been satisfied, (e.g., when one is full after eating), the state of satiety, of no longer being in need or want, is itself pleasurable. Epicurus calls this a ‘static’ pleasure, and says that these static pleasures are the best pleasures.

Because of this, Epicurus denies that there is any intermediate state between pleasure and pain. When one has unfulfilled desires, this is painful, and when one no longer has unfulfilled desires, this steady state is the most pleasurable of all, not merely some intermediate state between pleasure and pain.

Epicurus also distinguishes between physical and mental pleasures and pains. Physical pleasures and pains concern only the present, whereas mental pleasures and pains also encompass the past (fond memories of past pleasure or regret over past pain or mistakes) and the future (confidence or fear about what will occur). The greatest destroyer of happiness, thinks Epicurus, is anxiety about the future, especially fear of the gods and fear of death. If one can banish fear about the future, and face the future with confidence that one’s desires will be satisfied, then one will attain tranquility (ataraxia), the most exalted state. In fact, given Epicurus’ conception of pleasure, it might be less misleading to call him a ‘tranquillist’ instead of a ‘hedonist.’

c. Types of Desire

Because of the close connection of pleasure with desire-satisfaction, Epicurus devotes a considerable part of his ethics to analyzing different kinds of desires. If pleasure results from getting what you want (desire-satisfaction) and pain from not getting what you want (desire-frustration), then there are two strategies you can pursue with respect to any given desire: you can either strive to fulfill the desire, or you can try to eliminate the desire. For the most part Epicurus advocates the second strategy, that of paring your desires down to a minimum core, which are then easily satisfied.

Epicurus distinguishes between three types of desires: natural and necessary desires, natural but non-necessary desires, and “vain and empty” desires. Examples of natural and necessary desires include the desires for food, shelter, and the like. Epicurus thinks that these desires are easy to satisfy, difficult to eliminate (they are ‘hard-wired’ into human beings naturally), and bring great pleasure when satisfied. Furthermore, they are necessary for life, and they are naturally limited: that is, if one is hungry, it only takes a limited amount of food to fill the stomach, after which the desire is satisfied. Epicurus says that one should try to fulfill these desires.

Vain desires include desires for power, wealth, fame, and the like. They are difficult to satisfy, in part because they have no natural limit. If one desires wealth or power, no matter how much one gets, it is always possible to get more, and the more one gets, the more one wants. These desires are not natural to human beings, but inculcated by society and by false beliefs about what we need; e.g., believing that having power will bring us security from others. Epicurus thinks that these desires should be eliminated.

An example of a natural but non-necessary desire is the desire for luxury food. Although food is needed for survival, one does not need a particular type of food to survive. Thus, despite his hedonism, Epicurus advocates a surprisingly ascetic way of life. Although one shouldn’t spurn extravagant foods if they happen to be available, becoming dependent on such goods ultimately leads to unhappiness. As Epicurus puts it, “If you wish to make Pythocles wealthy, don’t give him more money; rather, reduce his desires.” By eliminating the pain caused by unfulfilled desires, and the anxiety that occurs because of the fear that one’s desires will not be fulfilled in the future, the wise Epicurean attains tranquility, and thus happiness.

d. The Virtues

Epicurus’ hedonism was widely denounced in the ancient world as undermining traditional morality. Epicurus, however, insists that courage, moderation, and the other virtues are needed in order to attain happiness. However, the virtues for Epicurus are all purely instrumental goods–that is, they are valuable solely for the sake of the happiness that they can bring oneself, not for their own sake. Epicurus says that all of the virtues are ultimately forms of prudence, of calculating what is in one’s own best interest. In this, Epicurus goes against the majority of Greek ethical theorists, such as the Stoics, who identify happiness with virtue, and Aristotle, who identifies happiness with a life of virtuous activity. Epicurus thinks that natural science and philosophy itself also are instrumental goods. Natural science is needed in order to give mechanistic explanations of natural phenomena and thus dispel the fear of the gods, while philosophy helps to show us the natural limits of our desires and to dispel the fear of death.

e. Justice

Epicurus is one of the first philosophers to give a well-developed contractarian theory of justice. Epicurus says that justice is an agreement “neither to harm nor be harmed,” and that we have a preconception of justice as “what is useful in mutual associations.” People enter into communities in order to gain protection from the dangers of the wild, and agreements concerning the behavior of the members of the community are needed in order for these communities to function, e.g., prohibitions of murder, regulations concerning the killing and eating of animals, and so on. Justice exists only where there are such agreements.

Like the virtues, justice is valued entirely on instrumental grounds, because of its utility for each of the members of society. Epicurus says that the main reason not to be unjust is that one will be punished if one gets caught, and that even if one does not get caught, the fear of being caught will still cause pain. However, he adds that the fear of punishment is needed mainly to keep fools in line, who otherwise would kill, steal, etc. The Epicurean wise man recognizes the usefulness of the laws, and since he does not desire great wealth, luxury goods, political power, or the like, he sees that he has no reason to engage in the conduct prohibited by the laws in any case.

Although justice only exists where there is an agreement about how to behave, that does not make justice entirely ‘conventional,’ if by ‘conventional’ we mean that any behavior dictated by the laws of a particular society is thereby just, and that the laws of a particular society are just for that society. Since the ‘justice contract’ is entered into for the purpose of securing what is useful for the members of the society, only laws that are actually useful are just. Thus, a prohibition of murder would be just, but antimiscegenation laws would not. Since what is useful can vary from place to place and time to time, what laws are just can likewise vary.

f. Friendship

Epicurus values friendship highly and praises it in quite extravagant terms. He says that friendship “dances around the world” telling us that we must “wake to blessedness.” He also says that the wise man is sometimes willing to die for a friend. Because of this, some scholars have thought that in this area, at least, Epicurus abandons his egoistic hedonism and advocates altruism toward friends. This is not clear, however. Epicurus consistently maintains that friendship is valuable because it is one of the greatest means of attaining pleasure. Friends, he says, are able to provide one another the greatest security, whereas a life without friends is solitary and beset with perils. In order for there to be friendship, Epicurus says, there must be trust between friends, and friends have to treat each other as well as they treat themselves. The communities of Epicureans can be seen as embodying these ideals, and these are ideals that ultimately promote ataraxia.

g. Death

One of the greatest fears that Epicurus tries to combat is the fear of death. Epicurus thinks that this fear is often based upon anxiety about having an unpleasant afterlife; this anxiety, he thinks, should be dispelled once one realizes that death is annihilation, because the mind is a group of atoms that disperses upon death.

i. The No Subject of Harm Argument

If death is annihilation, says Epicurus, then it is ‘nothing to us.’ Epicurus’ main argument for why death is not bad is contained in the Letter to Menoeceus and can be dubbed the ‘no subject of harm’ argument. If death is bad, for whom is it bad? Not for the living, since they’re not dead, and not for the dead, since they don’t exist. His argument can be set out as follows:

1. Death is annihilation.
2. The living have not yet been annihilated (otherwise they wouldn’t be alive).
3. Death does not affect the living. (from 1 and 2)
4. So, death is not bad for the living. (from 3)
5. For something to be bad for somebody, that person has to exist, at least.
6. The dead do not exist. (from 1)
7. Therefore, death is not bad for the dead. (from 5 and 6)
8. Therefore death is bad for neither the living nor the dead. (from 4 and 7)

Epicurus adds that if death causes you no pain when you’re dead, it’s foolish to allow the fear of it to cause you pain now.

ii. The Symmetry Argument

A second Epicurean argument against the fear of death, the so-called ‘symmetry argument,’ is recorded by the Epicurean poet Lucretius. He says that anyone who fears death should consider the time before he was born. The past infinity of pre-natal non-existence is like the future infinity of post-mortem non-existence; it is as though nature has put up a mirror to let us see what our future non-existence will be like. But we do not consider not having existed for an eternity before our births to be a terrible thing; therefore, neither should we think not existing for an eternity after our deaths to be evil.

6. References and Further Reading

This is not meant as comprehensive bibliography; rather, it’s a selection of further texts to read for those who want to learn more about Epicurus and Epicureanism. Most of the books listed below have extensive bibliographies for those looking for more specialized and scholarly publications.

a. Collections of Primary Source

• The Epicurus Reader, translated and edited by Brad Inwood and L.P. Gerson, Hackett Publishing.
  • This inexpensive collection has most of the major extant writings of Epicurus, in addition to other ancient sources such as Cicero and Plutarch who wrote about Epicureanism. (Lucretius is not included much.) However, there is little commentary or explication of the material, and some of the primary sources are fairly opaque.
• The Hellenistic philosophers, Volume 1: translations of the principal sources, with philosophical commentary, by A.A. Long and D.N. Sedley, Cambridge University Press.
  • This excellent book organizes the texts into sections topically, (e.g., “Atoms,” “Soul,” “Language,” “Death,”) and follows each selection of texts with commentary and explication. Vol. 2, which contains the original Greek and Latin texts, has a fine, if somewhat dated (1987) bibliography at the end.Lucretius, De Rerum Natura

There are many different editions of Lucretius’ masterpiece, an extended exposition of Epicurus’ metaphysics, philosophy of mind, and natural science. I personally like the translation by Rolfe Humphries: Lucretius: The Way Things Are. The De Rerum Natura of Titus Lucretius Carus, Indiana University Press. Humphries translates Lucretius’ poem as a poem, not as prose, yet the translation is still very clear and readable.

b. Recent Books on Particular Areas of Epicurus’ Philosophy

The books below are all well-written and influential. They deal in-depth with problems of interpreting particular areas of Epicurus’ philosophy, while still remaining, for the most part, accessible to well-educated general readers. They also have extensive bibliographies. However, do not assume that the interpretations of Epicurus in these books are always widely accepted.

• Hellenistic Philosophy of Mind, by Julia Annas, University of California Press.
  • This book deals with Epicurean and Stoic theories of what the mind is.
• Epicurus’ Ethical Theory : The Pleasures of Invulnerability, by Phillip Mitsis, Cornell University Press.
  • This book is concerned with all of the major areas of Epicurean ethics, from pleasure, to friendship, justice, and human freedom. Mitsis is especially good at showing how Epicurus’ conception of pleasure differs from that of the utilitarians.
• The Morality of Happiness, by Julia Annas, Oxford University Press.
  • This book focuses deals with all major ancient theorists from Aristotle on, but is still a good source of information on Epicurean ethics, especially if one wants to put Epicurean ethics in the context of other ancient ethical theories.
• Epicurus’ Scientific Method, by Elizabeth Asmis, Cornell University Press.
  • The best book-length treatment of Epicurus’ epistemology available. A little more technical than the books above, but still fairly accessible.

Author Information

Tim O’Keefe
Email: see web page
Georgia State University
U. S. A.

Epictetus (55–135 C.E.)

Epictetus (pronounced Epic-TEE-tus) was an exponent of Stoicism who flourished in the early second century C.E. about four hundred years after the Stoic school of Zeno of Citium was established in Athens. He lived and worked, first as a student in Rome, and then as a teacher with his own school in Nicopolis in Greece. Our knowledge of his philosophy and his method as a teacher comes to us via two works composed by his student Arrian, the Discourses and the Handbook. Although Epictetus based his teaching on the works of the early Stoics (none of which survives) which dealt with the three branches of Stoic thought, logic, physics and ethics, the Discourses and the Handbook concentrate almost exclusively on ethics. The role of the Stoic teacher was to encourage his students to live the philosophic life, whose end was eudaimonia (‘happiness’ or ‘flourishing’), to be secured by living the life of reason, which – for Stoics – meant living virtuously and living ‘according to nature’. The eudaimonia (‘happiness’) of those who attain this ideal consists of ataraxia (imperturbability), apatheia (freedom from passion), eupatheiai (‘good feelings’), and an awareness of, and capacity to attain, what counts as living as a rational being should. The key to transforming oneself into the Stoic sophos (wise person) is to learn what is ‘in one’s power’, and this is ‘the correct use of impressions’ (phantasiai), which in outline involves not judging as good or bad anything that appears to one. For the only thing that is good is acting virtuously (that is, motivated by virtue), and the only thing that is bad is the opposite, acting viciously (that is, motivated by vice). Someone who seeks to make progress as a Stoic (a prokoptôn) understands that their power of rationality is a fragment of God whose material body – a sort of rarefied fiery air – blends with the whole of creation, intelligently forming and directing undifferentiated matter to make the world as we experience it. The task of the prokoptôn, therefore, is to ‘live according to nature’, which means (a) pursuing a course through life intelligently responding to one’s own needs and duties as a sociable human being, but also (b) wholly accepting one’s fate and the fate of the world as coming directly from the divine intelligence which makes the world the best that is possible.

Table of Contents

1. Life
2. Writings
   1. The Discourses
   2. The Handbook
3. Epictetus’ Stoicism
4. Key Concepts
   1. The Promise of Philosophy
   2. What is Really Good
   3. What is in our Power
   4. Making Proper Use of Impressions
   5. The Three Topoi
      1. The Discipline of Desire
      2. The Discipline of Action
      3. The Discipline of Assent
   6. God
   7. On Living in Accord with Nature
   8. Metaphors for Life
   9. Making Progress
5. Glossary of Terms
6. References and Further Reading
   1. Translations of Epictetus
   2. Translations of Hellenistic Philosophers, including the Stoics
   3. Items that Address Epictetus Specifically
   4. Items Addressing Stoic Philosophy and/or Hellenistic Ethics Generally
   5. Other Items on Hellenistic Philosophy Generally

1. Life

It is possible to draw only a basic sketch of Epictetus’ life. Resources at our disposal include just a handful of references in the ancient texts, to which we can add the few allusions that Epictetus makes to his own life in the Discourses.

Epictetus was born in about 55 C.E. in Hierapolis in Phrygia (modern-day Pamukkale, in south-western Turkey). As a boy he somehow came to Rome as a slave of Epaphroditus who was a rich and powerful freedman, having himself been a slave of the Emperor Nero (he had been an administrative secretary). Whilst still a slave, Epictetus studied with the Stoic teacher Musonius Rufus.

There is a story told by the author Celsus (probably a younger contemporary of Epictetus) – quoted by the early Christian Origen (c.185–254) at Contra Celsum 7.53 – that when still a slave, Epictetus was tortured by his master who twisted his leg. Enduring the pain with complete composure, Epictetus warned Epaphroditus that his leg would break, and when it did break, he said, ‘There, did I not tell you that it would break?’ And from that time Epictetus was lame. The Suda (tenth century), however, although confirming that Epictetus was lame, attributes his affliction to rheumatism.

At some point Epictetus was manumitted, and in about 89, along with other philosophers then in Rome, was banished by the Emperor Domitian. He went to Nicopolis in Epirus (in north-western Greece) where he opened his own school which acquired a good reputation, attracting many upper-class Romans. One such student was Flavius Arrian (c.86–160) who would compose the Discourses and the Handbook, and who later served in public office under the Emperor Hadrian and made his mark as a respected historian (much of his writings survive). Origen (Contra Celsum 6.2) reports that Epictetus had been more popular in his day than had Plato in his. Aulus Gellius (c.125–c.165) reports that one of Marcus Aurelius’ teachers, Herodes Atticus (c.101–177), considered Epictetus to be ‘the greatest of Stoics’ (Attic Nights 1.2.6).

Our sources report that Epictetus did not marry, had no children, and lived to an old age. With respect to marriage and children we may note the story from Lucian (Demonax 55) about the Cynic philosopher Demonax who had been a pupil of Epictetus. On hearing Epictetus exhort his students to marry and have children (for it was a philosopher’s duty to provide a substitute ready for the time when they would die), he sarcastically asked Epictetus whether he could marry one of his daughters.

2. Writings

It appears that Epictetus wrote nothing himself. The works we have that present his philosophy were written by his student, Flavius Arrian. We may conjecture that the Discourses and the Handbook were written some time around the years 104–107, at the time when Arrian (born c.86) was most likely to have been a student.

Dobbin (1998), though, holds the view that the Discourses and the Handbook were actually written by Epictetus himself; the Suda does say, after all, that Epictetus ‘wrote a great deal’. Dobbin is not entirely convinced by Arrian’s claim in his dedicatory preface that he wrote down Epictetus’ words verbatim; firstly, stenographic techniques at this time were primitive, and anyway were the preserve of civil servants; secondly, most of the discourses are too polished, and look too much like carefully crafted prose to be the product of impromptu discussions; and thirdly, some of the discourses (notably 1.29, 3.22 and 4.1) are too long for extempore conversations.

There is no way to resolve this question with certainty. Whether the texts we have do indeed represent a serious attempt to record Epictetus at work verbatim, whether draft texts were later edited and rewritten (as seems wholly likely), possibly by Epictetus, or whether Epictetus did in fact write the texts himself, drawing on his recollections as a lecturer with only occasional attempts at strictly verbatim accuracy, we shall never know. But what we can be certain of, regardless of who actually wrote the words onto the papyrus to make the first draft of the text as we have it today, is that those words were intended to present Stoic moral philosophy in the terms and the style that Epictetus employed as a teacher intent on bringing his students to philosophic enlightenment as the Stoics had understood this enterprise.

a. Discourses

Written in Koine Greek, the everyday contemporary form of the language, Epictetus’ Discourses appear to record the exchanges between Epictetus and his students after formal teaching had concluded for the day. Internal textual evidence confirms that the works of the early Stoic philosophers (Zeno, Cleanthes and Chrysippus) were read and discussed in Epictetus’ classes, but this aspect of Epictetus’ teaching is not recorded by Arrian. What we have, then, are intimate, though earnest, discussions in which Epictetus aims to make his students consider carefully what the philosophic life – for a Stoic – consists in, and how to live it oneself. He discusses a wide range of topics, from friendship to illness, from fear to poverty, on how to acquire and maintain tranquillity, and why we should not be angry with other people.

Not all of the Discourses appear to have survived, as the ancient Byzantine scholar Photius (c.810–c.893) reports that the complete text originally comprised eight books, whereas all we have today are four books. Because the text, chapter by chapter, jumps to different topics and shows no orderly development, it is not readily apparent that anything is missing, and indeed, the reference to eight books may be mistaken (though another author, Aulus Gellius, at Attic Nights 19.1.14, refers to the fifth book of the Discourses). The range of topics is sufficiently broad for us to be reasonably confident that, even if some of the text has been lost, what we lack by and large repeats and revisits the material that we have in the book as it has come down to us.

b. The Handbook

This little book appears to be an abstract of the Discourses, focusing on key themes in Epictetus’ teaching of Stoic ethics. Some of the text is taken from the Discourses, and the fact that not all of it can be correlated with passages in the larger work supports the view that some of the Discourses has indeed been lost.

3. Epictetus’ Stoicism

The writings of the early Stoics, of Zeno (335–263 B.C.E.) the founder of the school, of Chrysippus (c.290–207 B.C.E.) the extremely influential third head of the Stoa, and of others, survive only as quoted fragments found in later works. The question arises as to what extent Epictetus preserved the original doctrines of the Stoic school, and to what extent, if any, he branched out with new emphases and innovations of his own. The nineteenth-century Epictetan scholar Adolf Bonhöffer (1998, 3) remarks: ‘[Epictetus] is completely free of the eclecticism of Seneca and Marcus Aurelius; and, compared with his teacher Musonius Rufus … his work reveals a considerably closer connection to Stoic doctrine and terminology as developed mainly by Chrysippus.’ Evidence internal to the Discourses indicates that Epictetus was indeed faithful to the early Stoics. At 1.4.28–31, Epictetus praises Chrysippus in the highest terms, saying of him, ‘How great the benefactor who shows the way! … who has discovered, and brought to light, and communicated, the truth to all, not merely of living, but of living well’ (trans. Hard). It would be inconsistent, if not wholly ridiculous, to laud Chrysippus in such terms and then proceed to depart oneself from the great man’s teaching. At 1.20.15, Epictetus quotes Zeno, and at 2.6.9–10 he quotes Chrysippus, to support his arguments. Aulus Gellius (Attic Nights 19.1.14) says that Epictetus’ Discourses ‘undoubtedly agree with the writings of Zeno and Chrysippus’.

Scholars are agreed that the ‘doctrine of the three topics (topoi)’ (fields of study) which we find in the Discourses originates with Epictetus (see Bonhöffer 1996, 32; Dobbin 1998, xvii; Hadot 1998, 83; More 1923, 107). Oldfather (1925, xxi, n. 1), in the introduction to his translation of the Discourses, remarks that ‘this triple division … is the only notable original element … found in Epictetus, and it is rather a pedagogical device for lucid presentation than an innovation in thought’. Our enthusiasm for this division being wholly original to Epictetus should be tempered with a reading of extracts from Seneca’s Moral Letters (75.8–18 and 89.14–15) where we also find a threefold division of ethics which, although not exactly similar to Epictetus’ scheme, suggests the possibility that both Seneca and Epictetus drew on work by their predecessors that, alas, has not survived. Suffice it so say, what Epictetus teaches by means of his threefold division is wholly in accord with the principles of the early Stoics, but how he does this is uniquely his own method. The programme of study and exercises that Epictetus’ students adhered to was in consequence different from the programme that was taught by his predecessors, but the end result, consisting in the special Stoic outlook on oneself and the world at large and the ability to ‘live the philosophic life’, was the same.

4. Key Concepts

a. The Promise of Philosophy

Epictetus, along with all other philosophers of the Hellenistic period, saw moral philosophy as having the practical purpose of guiding people towards leading better lives. The aim was to live well, to secure for oneself eudaimonia (‘happiness’ or ‘a flourishing life’), and the different schools and philosophers of the period offered differing solutions as to how the eudaimôn life was to be won.

No less true of us today than it was for the ancients, few people are content with life (let alone wholly content), and what contributes to any contentment that may be enjoyed is almost certainly short-lived and transient.

The task for the Stoic teacher commences with the understanding that (probably) everyone is not eudaimôn for much, or even all, of the time; that there is a reason for this being the case and, most importantly, that there are solutions that can remedy this sorry state of affairs.

Indeed, Epictetus metaphorically speaks of his school as being a hospital to which students would come seeking treatments for their ills (Discourses 3.23.30). Each of us, in consequence merely of being human and living in society, is well aware of what comprise these ills. In the course of daily life we are beset by frustrations and setbacks of every conceivable type. Our cherished enterprises are hindered and thwarted, we have to deal with hostile and offensive people, and we have to cope with the difficulties and anxieties occasioned by the setbacks and illnesses visited upon our friends and relations. Sometimes we are ill ourselves, and even those who have the good fortune to enjoy sound health have to face the fact of their own mortality. In the midst of all this, only the rare few are blessed with lasting and rewarding relationships, and even these relationships, along with everything that constitutes a human life, are wholly transient.

But what is philosophy? Does it not mean making preparation to meet the things that come upon us? (Discourses 3.10.6, trans. Oldfather)

The ills we suffer, says Epictetus, result from mistaken beliefs about what is truly good. We have invested our hope in the wrong things, or at least invested it in the wrong way. Our capacity to flourish and be happy (to attain eudaimonia) is entirely dependent upon our own characters, how we dispose ourselves to ourselves, to others, and to events generally. What qualities our characters come to have is completely up to us. Therefore, how well we flourish is also entirely up to us.

b. What is Really Good

The central claim of Stoic ethics is that only the virtues and virtuous activities are good, and that the only evil is vice and actions motivated by vice (see Discourses 2.9.15 and 2.19.13). When someone pursues pleasure or wealth, say, believing these things to be good, the Stoics hold that this person has made a mistake with respect to the nature of the things pursued and the nature of their own being, for the Stoics deny that advantages such as pleasure and health (wealth and status, and so forth) are good, because they do not benefit those who possess them in all circumstances. Virtue, on the other hand, conceived as the capacity to use such advantages wisely, being the only candidate for that which is always beneficial, is held to be the only good thing (see Plato, Euthydemus 278e–281e and Meno 87c–89a).

Thus, the Stoics identify the eudaimôn (‘happy’) life as one that is motivated by virtue. The term we translate as ‘virtue’ (from the Latin virtus) is aretê, and means ‘excellence’. To progress towards excellence as a human being, for Epictetus, means understanding the true nature of one’s being and keeping one’s prohairesis (moral character) in the right condition. Epictetus uses the term aretê only occasionally, and whereas the early Stoics spoke of striving for excellence as what was proper for a rational creature and required for eudaimonia (‘happiness’ or well-being), Epictetus speaks of striving to maintain one’s prohairesis in proper order (see Discourses 1.4.18 and 1.29.1).

Although things such as material comfort, for instance, will be pursued by the Stoic student who seeks eudaimonia, they will do this in a different way from those not living the ‘philosophic life’ – for Stoics claim that everything apart from virtue (what is good) and vice (what is bad) is indifferent, that is, ‘indifferent’ with regard to being good or bad. It is how one makes use of indifferent things that establishes how well one is making progress towards aretê (moral excellence) and a eudaimôn (‘happy’) life.

Indifferent things are either ‘preferred’ or ‘dispreferred’. Preferred are health and wealth, friends and family, and pretty much all those things that most people pursue as desirable for leading a flourishing life. Dispreferred are their opposites: sickness and poverty, social exclusion, and pretty much all those things that people seek to avoid as being detrimental for a flourishing life. Thus, the preferred indifferents have value for a Stoic, but not in terms of their being good: they have an instrumental value with respect to their capacities to contribute to a flourishing life as the objects upon which our virtuous actions are directed (see Discourses 1.29.2). The Stoic does not lament their absence, for their presence is not constitutive of eudaimonia. What is good is the virtuous use one makes of such preferred things should they be to hand, but no less good are one’s virtuous dispositions in living as well as one may, even when they are lacking.

c. What is in our Power

To maintain our prohairesis (moral character) in the proper condition – the successful accomplishment of this being necessary and sufficient for eudaimonia (‘happiness’) – we must understand what is eph’ hêmin (‘in our power’ or ‘up to us’; see Discourses 1.22.9–16). If we do not do this, our prohairesis will remain in a faulty condition, for we will remain convinced that things such as wealth and status are good when they are really indifferent, troubled by frustrations and anxieties, subject to disturbing emotions we do not want and cannot control, all of which make life unpleasant and unrewarding, sometimes overwhelmingly so. This is why Epictetus remarks: ‘This is the proper goal, to practise how to remove from one’s life sorrows and laments, and cries of “Alas” and “Poor me”, and misfortune and disappointment’ (Discourses 1.4.23, trans. Dobbin).

No one is master of another’s prohairesis [moral character], and in this alone lies good and evil. No one, therefore, can secure the good for me, or involve me in evil, but I alone have authority over myself in these matters. (Discourses 4.12.7–8, trans. Dobbin)

What is in our power, then, is the ‘authority over ourselves’ that we have regarding our capacity to judge what is good and what is evil. Outside our power are ‘external things’, which are ‘indifferent’ with respect to being good or evil. These indifferents, as we saw in the previous section, number those things that are conventionally deemed to be good and those that are conventionally deemed to be bad. Roughly, they are things that ‘just happen’, and they are not in our power in the sense that we do not have absolute control to make them occur just as we wish, or to make them have exactly the outcomes that we desire. Thus, for example, sickness is not in our power because it is not wholly up to us whether we get sick, and how often, nor whether we will recover quickly or indeed at all. Now, it makes sense to visit a doctor when we feel ill, but the competence of the doctor is not in our power, and neither is the effectiveness of any treatment that we might be offered. So generally, it makes sense to manage our affairs carefully and responsibly, but the ultimate outcome of any affair is, actually, not in our power.

What is in our power is the capacity to adapt ourselves to all that comes about, to judge anything that is ‘dispreferred’ not as bad, but as indifferent and not strong enough to overwhelm our strength of character.

The Handbook of Epictetus begins with these words:

Some things are up to us [eph’ hêmin] and some things are not up to us. Our opinions are up to us, and our impulses, desires, aversions–in short, whatever is our own doing. Our bodies are not up to us, nor are our possessions, our reputations, or our public offices, or, that is, whatever is not our own doing. (Handbook 1.1, trans. White)

That is, we have power over our own minds. The opinions we hold of things, the intentions we form, what we value and what we are averse to are all wholly up to us. Although we may take precautions, whether our possessions are carried off by a thief is not up us (but the intention to steal, that of course is in the power of the thief), and our reputations, in whatever quarter, must be decided by what other people think of us, and what they do think is up to them. Remaining calm in the face of adversity and controlling our emotions no matter what the provocation (qualities of character that to this day are referred to as ‘being stoical’), are accomplished in the full Stoic sense, for Epictetus, by making proper use of impressions.

d. Making Proper Use of Impressions

To have an impression is to be aware of something in the world. For example, I may look out of my window and have the impression of an airship floating over the houses in the distance. Whether there is really an airship there, half a mile off, or whether there is just a little helium-filled model tied to my garden gate by a bit of string, is a separate question. ‘Making proper use of impressions’ concerns how we move from the first thing, being aware of something or other, to the second thing, making a judgement that something or other is the case. The Stoic stands in sharp contrast to the non-Stoic, for when the latter faces some disaster, say (let us imagine that their briefcase has burst open and their papers are scattered by the wind all along the station platform and onto the track), they will judge this a terrible misfortune and have the appropriate emotional response to match. Epictetus would declare that this person has made the wrong use of their impression.

In the first place, do not allow yourself to be carried away by [the] intensity [of your impression]: but say, ‘Impression, wait for me a little. Let me see what you are, and what you represent. Let me test you.’ Then, afterwards, do not allow it to draw you on by picturing what may come next, for if you do, it will lead you wherever it pleases. But rather, you should introduce some fair and noble impression to replace it, and banish this base and sordid one. (Discourses 2.18.24–5, trans. Hard)

Few non-Stoics, ignorant of Epictetus’ teaching, would do other than rush around after their papers, descending deeper and deeper into a panic, imagining their boss at work giving them a dressing down for losing the papers, making them work extra hours to make good the loss, and perhaps even dismissing them from their job. The Stoic, by contrast, tests their impression to see what the best interpretation should be: losing the papers is a dispreferred indifferent, to be sure, but having an accident of this sort is bound to happen once in a while, and is nothing to be troubled about. They will quietly gather up the papers they can, and instead of panicking with respect to facing their boss, they will rehearse a little speech about having had an accident and what it means to have lost the papers. If their boss erupts in a temper, well, that is a concern for the boss.

Our attaining the eudaimôn (‘happy’) life requires that we judge things in the right way, for ‘what disturbs men’s minds is not events but their judgements on events’ (Handbook 5, trans. Matheson).

Remember that foul words or blows in themselves are no outrage, but your judgement that they are so. So when any one makes you angry, know that it is your own thought that has angered you. Wherefore make it your endeavour not to let your impressions carry you away. For if once you gain time and delay, you will find it easier to control yourself. (Handbook 20, trans. Matheson)

e. The Three Topoi

The three topoi (fields of study) establish activities in which the prokoptôn (Stoic student) applies their Stoic principles; they are practical exercises or disciplines that when successfully followed are constitutive of the eudaimôn (‘happy’) life which all rational beings are capable of attaining.

There are three areas of study, in which a person who is going to be good and noble must be trained. That concerning desires and aversions, so that he may never fail to get what he desires nor fall into what he would avoid. That concerning the impulse to act and not to act, and, in general, appropriate behaviour; so that he may act in an orderly manner and after due consideration, and not carelessly. The third is concerned with freedom from deception and hasty judgement, and, in general, whatever is connected with assent. (Discourses 3.2.1–2, trans. Hard)

Our capacity to employ these disciplines in the course of daily life is eph’ hêmin (‘in our power’ or ‘up to us’) because they depend on our opinions, judgements, intentions and desires which concern the way we regard things over which our prohairesis (moral character) has complete control.

i. The Discipline of Desire

The first discipline concerns what someone striving for excellence as a rational being should truly believe is worthy of desire, which for the Stoics is that which is truly good, virtue and action motivated by virtue.

Of these [three areas of study], the principle, and most urgent, is that which has to do with the passions; for these are produced in no other way than by the disappointment of our desires, and the incurring of our aversions. It is this that introduces disturbances, tumults, misfortunes, and calamities; and causes sorrow, lamentation and envy; and renders us envious and jealous, and thus incapable of listening to reason. (Discourses 3.2.3, trans. Hard)

Epictetus remarks: ‘When I see a man anxious, I say, What does this man want? If he did not want some thing which is not in his power, how could he be anxious?’ (Discourses 2.13.1, trans. Long). Those things that most of us, most of the time, seek after as being desirable, what we consider will make our lives go well, are things that are not in our power, and thus the hope we have for securing these things is placed in the hands of others or in the hands of fate. And when we are thwarted in our efforts to gain what we desire we become frustrated (or depressed or envious or angry, or all of these things). To be afflicted with such ‘passions’, says Epictetus, is the only real source of misery for human beings. Instead of trying to relieve ourselves of these unpleasant emotions by pressing all the harder to secure what we desire, we should rather place our hope not in ‘external’ things that are not in our power, but in our own dispositions and moral character. In short, we should limit our desire to virtue and to becoming (to the best of our capacities) examples of ‘excellence’. If we do not do this, the inevitable result is that we will continue to desire what we may fail to obtain or lose once we have it, and in consequence suffer the unhappiness of emotional disquiet (or worse). And as is the common experience of all people at some time or other, when we are in the grip of such emotions we run the risk of becoming blind to the best course of action, even when construed in terms of pursuing ‘external’ things.

The Stoic prokoptôn, in contrast, sets their hopes on excellence, recognising that this is where their power over things lies. They will still pursue those ‘preferred indifferent external’ things that are needed for fulfilling those functions and projects that they deem appropriate for them as individuals, and those they have obligations to meet. But they will not be distressed at setbacks or failure, nor at obstructive people, nor at other difficulties (illness, for instance), for none of these things is entirely up to them, and they engage in their affairs in full consciousness of this fact. It is in maintaining this consciousness of what is truly good (virtue), and awareness that the indifferent things are beyond their power, that makes this a discipline for the Stoic prokoptôn.

ii. The Discipline of Action

The second discipline concerns our ‘impulses to act and not to act’, that is, our motivations, and answers the question as to what we each should do as an individual in our own unique set of circumstances to successfully fulfil the role of a rational, sociable being who is striving for excellence.

The outcome of our actions is not wholly in our power, but our inclination to act one way rather than another, to pursue one set of objectives rather than others, this is in our power. The Stoics use the analogy of the archer shooting at a target to explain this notion. The ideal, of course, is to hit the centre of the target, though accomplishing this is not entirely in the archer’s power, for she cannot be certain how the wind will deflect the arrow from its path, nor whether her fingers will slip, nor whether (for it is within the bounds of possibility) the bow will break. The excellent archer does all within her power to shoot well, and she recognises that doing her best is the best she can do. The Stoic archer strives to shoot excellently, and will not be disappointed if she shoots well but fails to hit the centre of the target. And so it is in life generally. The non-Stoic views their success in terms of hitting the target, whereas the Stoic views their success in terms of having shot well (see Cicero, On Ends 3.22).

The [second area of study] has to do with appropriate action. For I should not be unfeeling like a statue, but should preserve my natural and acquired relations as a man who honours the gods, as a son, as a brother, as a father, as a citizen. (Discourses 3.2.4, trans. Hard)

Appropriate acts are in general measured by the relations they are concerned with. ‘He is your father.’ This means that you are called upon to take care of him, give way to him in all things, bear with him if he reviles or strikes you.
‘But he is a bad father.’
Well, have you any natural claim to a good father? No, only to a father.
‘My brother wrongs me.’
Be careful then to maintain the relation you hold to him, and do not consider what he does, but what you must do if your purpose is to keep in accord with nature. (Handbook 30, trans. Matheson)

The actions we undertake, Epictetus says, should be motivated by the specific obligations that we have in virtue of who we are, our natural relations to others, and what roles we have adopted in our dealings with the wider community (see Discourses 2.10.7–13). Put simply, our interest to live well as rational beings obliges us to act virtuously, to be patient, considerate, gentle, just, self-disciplined, even-tempered, dispassionate, unperturbed, and when necessary, courageous. This returns us to the central Stoic notion that the eudaimôn (‘happy’) life is realised by those who are motivated by virtue. The Discipline of Action points out to the prokoptôn how this should be applied in our practical affairs.

Epictetus sums up the first two disciplines:

We must have these principles ready to hand. Without them we must do nothing. We must set our mind on this object: pursue nothing that is outside us, nothing that is not our own, even as He that is mighty has ordained: pursuing what lies within our will [prohairetika], and all else [i.e., indifferent things] only so far as it is given to us. Further, we must remember who we are, and by what name we are called, and must try to direct our acts [kathêkonta] to fit each situation and its possibilities.
We must consider what is the time for singing, what the time for play, and in whose presence: what will be unsuited to the occasion; whether our companions are to despise us, or we to despise ourselves: when to jest, and whom to mock at: in a word, how one ought to maintain one’s character in society. Wherever you swerve from any of these principles, you suffer loss at once; not loss from without, but issuing from the very act itself. (Discourses 4.12.15–18, trans. Matheson)

The loss here is of course loss of eudaimonia.

Failing to ‘remember who we are’ will result in our failing to pursue those actions appropriate to our individual circumstances and commitments. Epictetus says that this happens because we forget what ‘name’ we have (son, brother, councillor, etc.), ‘for each of these names, if rightly considered, always points to the acts appropriate to it’ (Discourses 2.10.11, trans. Hard). To progress in the Discipline of Action, then, the prokoptôn must be conscious, moment by moment, of (a) which particular social role they are playing, and (b) which actions are required or appropriate for fulfilling that role to the highest standard.

iii. The Discipline of Assent

This exercise focuses on ‘assenting to impressions’, and continues the discussion already introduced in the section above on making proper use of impressions. ‘Assent’ translates the Greek sunkatathesis, which means ‘approve’, ‘agree’, or ‘go along with’. Thus, when we assent to an impression (phantasia) we are committing ourselves to it as a correct representation of how things are, and are saying, ‘Yes, this is how it is.’ The Discipline of Assent, then, is an exercise applied to our impressions in which we interpret and judge them in order to move from having the impression of something or other, to a declaration that such-and-such is the case.

The third area of study has to do with assent, and what is plausible and attractive. For, just as Socrates used to say that we are not to lead an unexamined life [see Plato, Apology 38a], so neither are we to accept an unexamined impression, but to say, ‘Stop, let me see what you are, and where you come from’, just as the night-watch say, ‘Show me your token.’ (Discourses 3.12.14–15, trans. Hard)

Make it your study then to confront every harsh impression with the words, ‘You are but an impression, and not at all what you seem to be’. Then test it by those rules that you possess; and first by this–the chief test of all–’Is it concerned with what is in our power or with what is not in our power?’ And if it is concerned with what is not in our power, be ready with the answer that it is nothing to you. (Handbook 1.5, trans. Matheson)

And we should do this with a view to avoiding falling prey to subjective (and false) evaluations so that we can be free from deception and from making rash judgements about how to proceed in the first two disciplines. For if we make faulty evaluations we will end up (with respect to the first discipline) having desires for the wrong things (namely, ‘indifferents’), and (with respect to the second discipline) acting inappropriately with regard to our duties and obligations. This is why Epictetus remarks that the third topic ‘concerns the security of the other two’ (Discourses 3.2.5, trans. Long).

Epictetus runs through a number of imaginary situations to show how we should be alert to the dangers of assenting to poorly evaluated impressions:

… We ought … to exercise ourselves daily to meet the impressions of our senses …. So-and-so’s son is dead. Answer, ‘That lies outside the sphere of the moral purpose, it is not an evil.’ His father has disinherited So-and-so; what do you think of it? ‘That lies outside the sphere of the moral purpose, it is not an evil.’ Caesar has condemned him. ‘That lies outside the sphere of the moral purpose, it is not an evil.’ He was grieved at all this. ‘That lies within the sphere of the moral purpose, it is an evil.’ He has borne up under it manfully. ‘That lies within the sphere of the moral purpose, it is a good.’ Now, if we acquire this habit, we shall make progress; for we shall never give our assent to anything but that of which we get a convincing sense-impression. His son is dead. What happened? His son is dead. Nothing else? Not a thing. His ship is lost. What happened? His ship is lost. He was carried off to prison. What happened? He was carried off to prison. But the observation: ‘He has fared ill,’ is an addition that each man makes on his own responsibility. (Discourses 3.8.1–5, trans. Oldfather)

What we must avoid, then, is adding to our impressions immediately and without proper evaluation any notion that something good or bad is at hand. For the only thing that is good is moral virtue, and the only harm that anyone can come to is to engage in affairs motivated by vice. Thus, to see the loss of a ship as a catastrophe would count as assenting to the wrong impression, for the impression that we have is that of just a ship being lost. To take the extra step of declaring that this is a misfortune and harmful would be to assent to an impression that is not in fact present, and would be a mistake. The loss of a ship, for a Stoic, is nothing more than a dispreferred indifferent, and does not constitute a harm.

f. God

For Epictetus, the terms ‘God’, ‘the gods’, and ‘Zeus’ are used interchangeably, and they appear frequently in the Discourses. In the Handbook, God is discussed as the ‘captain’ who calls us back on board ship, the subsequent voyage being a metaphor for our departure from life (see Handbook 7). God is also portrayed as ‘the Giver’ to whom we should return all those things we have enjoyed on loan when we lose close relatives or friends who die, and when we lose our possessions through misfortune (see Discourses 4.10.16 and Handbook 11).

If the Stoic making progress (the prokoptôn) understands God, the universe, and themselves in the right way, they ‘will never blame the gods, nor find fault with them’ (Handbook 31.1, trans. Oldfather):

Will you be angry and discontented with the ordinances of Zeus, which he, with the Fates who spun in his presence the thread of your destiny at the time of your birth, ordained and appointed? (Discourses 1.12.25, trans. Hard)

Indeed, they will pray to God to lead them to the fate that He has assigned them:

Lead me, Zeus, and you too, Destiny,
Wherever I am assigned by you;
I’ll follow and not hesitate,
But even if I do not wish to,
Because I’m bad, I’ll follow anyway.
(Handbook 53, trans. White = extract from Cleanthes’ Hymn to Zeus)

[For] God has stationed us to a certain place and way of life. (Discourses 1.9.24, trans. Dobbin)

Epictetus presents orthodox Stoic views on God. His justification for believing in God is expressed essentially along the lines of what we recognise as an argument from design. The order and harmony that we can perceive in the natural world (from astronomical events to the way plants grow and fruit in season) is attributed to a divine providence that orders and controls the entire cosmos intelligently and rationally (see Discourses 1.6.1–11, 1.14.1–6, 1.16.7–8 and 2.14.11/25–7). The Stoics were materialists, and God is conceived of as a type of fiery breath that blends perfectly with all other matter in the universe. In doing this, God transforms matter from undifferentiated ‘stuff’ into the varied forms that we see around us. This process is continuous, and God makes the world as it is, doing what it does, moment by moment. Just as the soul of a person is understood to bring alive and animate what would otherwise be dead and inert matter, so God is thought of as the ‘soul of the world’, and the universe is thought of as a sort of animal.

Stoics hold that the mind of each person is quite literally a fragment (apospasma) of God (see Discourses 2.8.11), and that the rationality that we each possess is in fact a fragment of God’s rationality; and this Epictetus primarily identifies as the capacity we have to make proper use of impressions (see Discourses 1.1.12). Epictetus expresses this in terms of what God has ‘given us’; He is conceived of as having constructed the universe in such a way that we have in our possession all that is within the compass of our own character or moral choice and nothing else, but this is no reason for complaint:

What has He given me for my own and subject to my authority, and what has He left for Himself? Everything within the sphere of the moral purpose He has given me, subjected them to my control, unhampered and unhindered. My body that is made of clay, how could He make that unhindered? Accordingly He has made it subject to the revolution of the universe–[along with] my property, my furniture, my house, my children, my wife. … But how should I keep them? In accordance with the terms upon which they have been given, and for as long as they can be given. But He who gave also takes away. …
And so, when you have received everything, and your very self, from Another [i.e., God], do you yet complain and blame the Giver, if He take something away from you? (Discourses 4.1.100–3, with omissions, trans. Oldfather)

The capacity that the prokoptôn has for understanding, accepting, and embracing this state of affairs, that this is indeed the nature of things, is another of the main foundation stones of Stoic ethics.

g. On Living in Accord with Nature

The outlook adopted and the activities performed by the Stoic student in pursuit of excellence, as detailed in the sections above, are frequently referred to collectively by Epictetus (following the Stoic tradition) as ‘following nature’ or ‘living in harmony with nature’. The Stoic prokoptôn maintains his ‘harmony with nature’ by being aware of why he acts as he does in terms of both (a) what his appropriate actions are, and (b) accepting what fate brings. If, for example, the prokoptôn is berated unfairly by his brother, he will not respond with angry indignation, for this would be ‘contrary to nature’, for nature has determined how brothers should rightly act towards each other (see Discourses 3.10.19–20). The task the Stoic student shoulders is to pursue actions appropriate to him as a brother, despite all and any provocation to act otherwise (see Handbook 30). This, for Epictetus, is a major component of what it means to keep one’s prohairesis (moral character) in harmony with nature (see Discourses 1.6.15, 3.1.25 and 3.16.15).

Keeping ourselves in harmony with nature requires that we focus on two things. Firstly, we must pay attention to our own actions so that we respond appropriately, and secondly we must pay attention to the world in which our actions take effect and which prompts those actions in the first place.

When you are about to undertake some action, remind yourself what sort of action it is. If you are going out for a bath, put before your mind what commonly happens at the baths: some people splashing you, some people jostling, others being abusive, and others stealing. So you will undertake this action more securely if you say to yourself, ‘I want to have a bath and also to keep my choice [prohairesis] in harmony with nature.’ And do likewise in everything you undertake. So, if anything gets in your way when you are having your bath, you will be ready to say, ‘I wanted not only to have a bath but also to keep my choice [prohairesis] in harmony with nature; and I shall not keep it so if I get angry at what happens.’ (Handbook 4, trans. Hard)

In this extract about going to the baths, Epictetus focuses more on accepting what fate brings, saying that we should anticipate the sorts of things that can happen, so that when they do we will not be surprised and will not be angry. In other situations, anticipation of trouble or misfortune is impossible, but all the same, the Stoic will accept their fate as what God has ordained for them, and this for Epictetus is the very essence of keeping in harmony with nature (see Discourses 1.4.18–21).

It is circumstances (difficulties) which show what men are. Therefore when a difficulty falls upon you, remember that God, like a trainer of wrestlers, has matched you with a rough young man. For what purpose? you may say. Why, that you may become an Olympic conqueror; but it is not accomplished without sweat. In my opinion no man has had a more profitable difficulty than you have had, if you choose to make use of it as an athlete would deal with a young antagonist. (Discourses 1.24.1–2, trans. Long)

Every problem we face in life should be understood as a new opportunity to strengthen our moral character, just as every new bout for the wrestler provides an opportunity for them to train their skill in wrestling.

To be instructed is this, to learn to wish that every thing may happen as it does. And how do things happen? As the disposer [i.e., God] has disposed them. And he has appointed summer and winter, and abundance and scarcity, and virtue and vice, and all such opposites for the harmony of the whole; and to each of us he has given a body, and parts of the body, and possessions, and companions.
Remembering then this disposition of things, we ought to go to be instructed, not that we may change the constitution of things, – for we have not the power to do it, nor is it better that we should have the power, – but in order that, as the things around us are what they are and by nature exist, we may maintain our minds in harmony with the things which happen. (Discourses 1.12.15–17, trans. Long)

The wise and good man … submits his own mind to him who administers the whole [i.e., God], as good citizens do to the law of the state. He who is receiving instruction ought to come to be instructed with this intention, How shall I follow the gods in all things, how shall I be contented with the divine administration, and how can I become free? For he is free to whom every thing happens according to his will [prohairesis], and whom no man can hinder. (Discourses 1.12.7–9, trans. Long)

In this last extract we see Epictetus refer to the ideal Stoic practice as that of ‘following the gods’. This means essentially the same as ‘following nature’, for God, who is immanent in the world (as the Stoics understand it) is identified with the way the world manifests, so if one follows nature, one must also be following God (see Discourses 1.20.15, 1.30.4, 4.7.20 and 4.10.14).

h. Metaphors for Life

Epictetus employs a number of metaphors to illustrate what the Stoic attitude to life should be.

Life as a festival

In this metaphor, Epictetus encourages us to think of life as a festival, arranged for our benefit by God, as something that we can live through joyously, able to put up with any hardships that befall us because we have our eye on the larger spectacle that is taking place. He asks his students:

Who are you, and for what purpose have you come? Was it not he [i.e., God] who brought you here? … And as what did he bring you here? Was it not as a mortal? Was it not as one who would live, with a little portion of flesh, upon this earth, and behold his governance and take part with him, for a short time, in his pageant and his festival? (Discourses 4.1.104, trans. Hard)

The whole thrust of Stoic ethics aims to persuade us that we should ourselves contribute to the festival by living as well as we may and fulfilling our duties as sociable citizens of God’s ‘great city of the universe’ (Discourses 3.22.4, trans. Hard). (See also Discourses 1.12.21, 2.14.23 and 4.4.24–7/46.)

Life as a game

At Discourses 2.5.2, in encouraging his students to appreciate that external things are indifferent (being neither good nor bad), Epictetus says that we should imitate those who play dice, for neither the dice nor the counters have any real value; what matters, and what is either good or bad, is the way we play the game. Similarly at 2.5.15–20, where Epictetus discusses the example of playing a ball game, no one considers for a moment whether the ball itself is good or bad, but only whether they can throw and catch it with the appropriate skill. What matters are the faculties of dexterity, speed and good judgement exhibited by the players, for it is in deploying these faculties effectively that any player is deemed to have played well. (See also Discourses 4.7.5/19/30–1.) Epictetus also uses the metaphor of playing games when discussing suicide, for just as someone stops playing a game when they are no longer amused by it, so it should be in life generally: if life should become unbearable, no one can force us to keep living it.

To summarize: remember that the door is open. Do not be more cowardly than children, but just as they say, when the game no longer pleases them, ‘I will play no more,’ you too, when things seem that way to you, should merely say, ‘I will play no more,’ and so depart; but if you stay, stop moaning. (Discourses 1.24.20, trans. Hard; see also 1.25.7–21 and 2.16.37)

Life as weaving

In this metaphor, the wool that the weaver uses to make cloth takes the place of the ball in the game; that is, whatever material comes our way, it is our duty to make proper use of it, and if possible make it into the best thing of its kind as we can (see Discourses 2.5.21–2).

Life as a play

We have already seen, when discussing the Discipline of Action, that Epictetus urges us to ‘remember who we are’ and what ‘name’ we have, because what role we play in life will determine which actions are appropriate for us. Obviously, the metaphor of life as a play expands on this idea, but also brings in the notion of our having to accept our fate, whatever that may be, since we do not ourselves chose the role we must play (for although we may aim for one role rather than another, we must recognise that our attaining it is not, in fact, ‘in our power’).

Remember that you are an actor in a play, which is as the author [i.e., God] wants it to be: short, if he wants it to be short; long, if he wants it to be long. If he wants you to act a poor man, a cripple, a public official, or a private person, see that you act it with skill. For it is your job to act well the part that is assigned to you; but to choose it is another’s. (Handbook 17, trans. Hard)

Life as an athletic contest

This metaphor invites us to see an analogy between one’s training in Stoic ethics as preparatory for living the philosophic life and someone’s training in athletics as preparatory for entering the contest in the arena. Epictetus addresses someone who has become distressed at not having enough leisure to study their philosophy books, saying:

For is not reading a kind of preparation for living, but living itself made up of things other than books? It is as if an athlete, when he enters the stadium, should break down and weep because he is not exercising outside. This is what you were exercising for; this is what the jumping-weights, and the sand and your young partners were all for. So are you now seeking for these, when it is the time for action? That is just as if, in the sphere of assent, when we are presented with impressions, some of which are evidently true and others not, instead of distinguishing between them, we should want to read a treatise On Direct Apprehension. (Discourses 4.4.11–13, trans. Hard)

Training to live a life that befits someone who strives for the Stoic ideal is directly compared to athletic training. Such training is difficult, demanding, and unpleasant; there is little point in showing eagerness for any endeavour if we have not properly assessed the demands that will be placed upon us, and in inevitably losing our original enthusiasm we will look foolish. This applies to philosophic training no less than to training as a wrestler in preparation for competing in the Olympic games (see Discourses 3.15.1–13 = Handbook 29). Elsewhere, Epictetus declares that delay is no longer possible, that we must meet the challenges that life throws at us:

Therefore take the decision right now that you must live as a full-grown man, as a man who is making progress; and all that appears to be best must be to you a law that cannot be transgressed. And if you are confronted with a hard task or with something pleasant, or with something held in high repute or no repute, remember that the contest is now, and that the Olympic games are now, and that it is no longer possible to delay the match, and that progress is lost and saved as a result of one defeat and even one moment of giving in. (Handbook 51.2, trans. Boter; see also Discourses 1.4.13–17, 1.18.21–3, 1.24.1–2 and 3.25.3)

Life as military service

This metaphor returns us to the Stoic idea that the universe is governed by God, and that, like it or not, we are all in service to God. The Stoic prokoptôn (student making progress) should understand that they should live life attempting to discharge this service to the highest standards. Epictetus addresses the person who is upset that they are obliged to travel abroad, causing their mother to be distressed at their absence.

Do you not know that life is a soldier’s service? One man must keep guard, another go out to reconnoitre, another take the field. It is not possible for all to stay where they are, nor is it better so. But you neglect to fulfil the orders of the general and complain, when some severe order is laid upon you; you do not understand to what a pitiful state you are bringing the army so far as in you lies; you do not see that if all follow your example there will be no one to dig a trench, or raise a palisade, no one to keep night watch or fight in the field, but every one will seem an unserviceable soldier.
… So too it is in the world; each man’s life is a campaign, and a long and varied one. It is for you to play the soldier’s part–do everything at the General’s bidding, divining his wishes, if it be possible. (Discourses 3.24.31–5, trans. Matheson; see also 1.9.24 and 1.16.20–1)

i. Making Progress

In making progress, the Stoic prokoptôn will pay a price. In standing to God, the world, society, herself and her undertakings in this new way (by accepting the Stoic notions of what is truly good, what is truly up to her, where her proper duties lie, and in considering her life to be one of service to God), the prokoptôn separates herself from the rest of society in fairly marked, if not profound, ways. For example, Epictetus wants his students to enjoy and participate in the ‘festival of life’, yet at the public games (for instance) they must not support any one individual, but must wish the winner to be he who actually wins; they must refrain entirely from shouting or laughing, and must not get carried away by the spectacle of the contest (Handbook 33.10). So whilst the prokoptôn’s friends immerse themselves fully in the games, cheering on their man and jeering at his opponent, the Stoic stands aloof and detached. Deliberately separating herself from the crowd is the price she pays for well-being (eudaimonia), dispassion (apatheia), tranquillity and imperturbability (ataraxia), along with the conviction that she is living as God intends.

But having declared her hand, the prokoptôn will pay in other ways also, for those around her will rebuke and ridicule her (Handbook 22), for in abandoning the values and practices common to the wider community, she will provoke hostility and suspicion. Yet there remains the hope that some at least will see the prokoptôn as someone whose wisdom has value for the community at large, as someone who serves as an example of how one may get along in the world without being overwhelmed by it, as someone with specific skills to offer, such as mediating family disputes and suchlike (see Discourses 1.15.5).

Epictetus characterises the differences between the non-philosopher and someone making progress in these terms:

This is the position and character of a layman: He never looks for either help or harm from himself, but only from externals. This is the position and character of the philosopher: He looks for all his help or harm from himself.
Signs of one who is making progress are: He censures no one, praises no one, blames no one, finds fault with no one, says nothing about himself as though he were somebody or knew something. When he is hampered or prevented, he blames himself. And if anyone compliments him, he smiles to himself at the person complimenting; while if anyone censures him, he makes no defence. He goes about like an invalid, being careful not to disturb, before it has grown firm, any part which is getting well. He has put away from himself every desire, and has transferred his aversion to those things only, of what is under our control [eph’ hêmin], which are contrary to nature. He exercises no pronounced choice in regard to anything. If he gives the appearance of being foolish or ignorant he does not care. In a word, he keeps guard against himself as though he were his own enemy lying in wait. (Handbook 48.1–3, trans. Oldfather)

Epictetus’ life as a Stoic teacher can perhaps be regarded as a personal quest to awaken to true philosophic enlightenment that person who will stand up proudly when his teacher pleads:

Pray, let somebody show me a person who is in such a good way that he can say, ‘I concern myself only with what is my own, with what is free from hindrance, and is by nature free. That is what is truly good, and this I have. But let all else be as god may grant; it makes no difference to me.’ (Discourses 4.13.24, trans. Hard)

For having attained such enlightenment himself (for surely this we must suppose), Epictetus devoted his life to raising up others from the crowd of humanity who could stand beside him and share in a perception of the universe and a way of life that any rational being is obliged to adopt in virtue of the nature of things.

5. Glossary of Terms

adiaphora

‘indifferent’; any of those things that are neither good or bad, everything, in fact, that does not fall under the headings ‘virtue’ or ‘vice’. The indifferents are what those lacking Stoic wisdom frequently take to have value (either positive or negative), and hence take to be desirable or undesirable. Pursuing them, or trying to avoid them, can lead to disturbing emotions that undermine one’s capacity to lead a eudaimôn life.

apatheia

freedom from passion, a constituent of the eudaimôn life.

aphormê

aversion; the opposite of hormê.

apoproêgmena

any ‘dispreferred’ indifferent, including such things as sickness, poverty, social exclusion, and so forth (conventionally ‘bad’ things). Suffering any of the dispreferred indifferents does not detract from the eudaimôn life enjoyed by the Stoic sophos. See proêgmena.

appropriate action

see kathêkon.

aretê

‘excellence’ or virtue; in the context of Stoic ethics the possession of ‘moral excellence’ will secure eudaimonia. For Epictetus, one acquires this by learning the correct use of impressions, following God, and following nature.

askesis

training or exercise undertaken by the Stoic prokoptôn striving to become a Stoic sophos.

assent

see sunkatathesis and phantasiai (impressions).

ataraxia

imperturbability, literally ‘without trouble’, sometimes translated as ‘tranquillity’; a state of mind that is a constituent of the eudaimôn life.

duty

see kathêkon.

ekklisis

avoidance; opposite of orexis.

ektos

‘external’; any of those things that fall outside the preserve of one’s prohairesis, including health, wealth, sickness, life, death, pain – what Epictetus calls aprohaireta, which are not in our power, the ‘indifferent‘ things.

emotion

see pathos.

end

see telos.

eph’ hêmin

what is in our power, or ‘up to us’ – namely, the correct use of impressions.

eudaimonia

‘happiness’ or ‘flourishing’ or ‘living well’. One achieves this end by learning the correct use of impressions following God, and following nature.

eupatheiai

‘good feelings’, possessed by the Stoic wise person (sophos) who experiences these special sorts of emotions, but does not experience irrational and disturbing passions.

excellence

see aretê.

external thing

see ektos.

God

see theos.

hêgemonikon

‘commanding faculty’ of the soul (psuchê); the centre of consciousness, the seat of all mental states, thought by the Stoics (and other ancients) to be located in the heart. It manifests four mental powers: the capacity to receive impressions, to assent to them, form intentions to act in response to them, and to do these things rationally. The Discourses talk of keeping the prohairesis in the right condition, and also of keeping the hêgemonikon in the right condition, and for Epictetus these notions are essentially interchangeable.

hormê

impulse to act; that which motivates an action.

impressions

see phantasiai.

indifferents

see adiaphora.

kathêkon

any ‘appropriate action’, ‘proper function’, or ‘duty’ undertaken by someone aiming to do what befits them as a responsible, sociable person. The appropriate actions are the subject of the second of the three topoi.

katorthôma

a ‘right action’ or ‘perfect action’ undertaken by the Stoic sophos, constituted by an appropriate action performed virtuously.

orexis

‘desire’ properly directed only at virtue.

passion

see pathos.

pathos

any of the disturbing emotions or ‘passions’ experienced by those who lack Stoic wisdom and believe that externals really are good or bad, when in fact they are ‘indifferent‘. A pathos according to the Stoics is a false judgement based on a misunderstanding of what is truly good and bad.

phantasiai

‘impressions’, what we are aware of in virtue of having experiences. Whereas non-rational animals respond to their impressions automatically (thus ‘using’ them), over and above using our impressions, human beings, being rational, can ‘attend to their use’ and, with practice, assent or not assent to them as we deem appropriate. The capacity to do this is what Epictetus strives to teach his students.

phusis

nature. To acquire eudaimonia one must ‘follow nature’, which means accepting our own fate and the fate of the world, as well as understanding what it means to be a rational being and strive for virtue. See aretê and God.

proêgmena

any ‘preferred’ indifferent, conventionally taken to be good, including such things as health and wealth, taking pleasure in the company of others, and so forth. Enjoying any of the preferred indifferents is not in itself constitutive of the eudaimôn life sought by the Stoic prokoptôn. See apoproêgmena.

prohairesis

‘moral character’, the capacity that rational beings have for making choices and intending the outcomes of their actions, sometimes translated as will, volition, intention, choice, moral choice, moral purpose. This faculty is understood by Stoics to be essentially rational. It is the faculty we use to ‘attend to impressions‘ and to give (or withhold) assent to impressions.

prokoptôn

one who is making progress (prokopê) in living as a Stoic, which for Epictetus means above all learning the correct use of impressions.

proper function

see kathêkon.

right action

see katorthôma.

sophos

the Stoic wise person who values only aretê and enjoys a eudaimôn life. The sophos enjoys a way of engaging in life that the prokoptôn strives to emulate and attain.

sunkatathesis

assent; a capacity of the prohairesis to judge the significance of impressions.

tarachê

disturbance, trouble; what one avoids when one enjoys ataraxia.

telos

end; that which we should pursue for its own sake and not for the sake of any other thing. For the Stoic, this is virtue. Epictetus formulates the end in several different but closely related ways. He says that the end is to maintain one’s prohairesis in proper order, to follow God, and to follow nature, all of which count as maintaining a eudaimôn life. The means by which this is to be accomplished is to apply oneself to the ‘three disciplines‘ assiduously.

theos

God, who is material, is a sort of fiery breath that blends with undifferentiated matter to create the forms that we find in the world around us. He is supremely rational, and despite our feelings to the contrary, makes the best world that it is possible to make. Epictetus says that we should ‘follow God’, that is, accept the fate that He bestows on us and on the world. Stoics understand that the rationality enjoyed by every human being (and any other rational beings, should there be any) is literally a fragment of God.

topoi

‘topics’. The ‘three topics’ or ‘fields of study’ which we find elucidated in the Discourses is an original feature of Epictetus’ educational programme. The three fields of study are: (1) The Discipline of Desire, concerned with desire and avoidance (orexis and ekklisis), and what is really good and desirable (virtue, using impressions properly, following God, and following nature); (2) The Discipline of Action, concerned with impulse and aversion (hormê and aphormê), and our ‘appropriate actions‘ or ‘duties’ with respect to living in our communities in ways that befit a rational being; and (3) The Discipline of Assent, concerned with how we should judge our impressions so as not to be carried away by them into anxiety or disturbing emotions with the likelihood of failing in the first two Disciplines.

virtue

from the Latin virtus which translates the Greek aretê, ‘excellence’.

Zeus

the name for God; Epictetus uses the terms ‘Zeus’, ‘God’, and ‘the gods’ interchangeably.

6. References and Further Reading

a. Translations of Epictetus

(Note: ‘Enchiridion‘, ‘Encheiridion‘, ‘Handbook‘, and ‘Manual‘ all refer to the same work. Items in print and currently available are indicated with an asterisk*.)

• *Boter, Gerard. 1999. The Encheiridion of Epictetus & its Three Christian Adaptations: Transmission & Critical Editions. Leiden: Brill.
• *Dobbin, Robert. 1998. Epictetus: Discourses Book 1. Oxford: Clarendon.
  • Includes commentary.
• *Hard, Robin. 1995. The Discourses of Epictetus. ed. with introduction and notes by Christopher Gill. London: Everyman/Dent.
  • Includes the complete Discourses, The Handbook, and Fragments.
• Higginson, Thomas Wentworth. 1890. The Works of Epictetus Consisting of His Discourses, in Four Books, The Enchiridion, and Fragments. Boston: Little, Brown, & Company.
• Higginson, Thomas Wentworth. 1944. Epictetus: Discourses and Enchiridion. Roslyn, NY: Walter J. Black.
  • Reprint of the nineteenth-century translation with minor editorial alterations.
• *Higginson, Thomas Wentworth. 1948. The Enchiridion. Upper Saddle River, NJ: Prentice Hall.
  • Reprint of nineteenth-century translation.
• *Lobell, Sharon. 1995. Epictetus: The Art of Living. The Classic Manual on Virtue, Happiness, and Effectiveness: A New Interpretation. San Francisco: HarperSanFrancisco.
  • A free paraphrase of the Handbook.
• Long, George. 1890. The Discourses of Epictetus with the Encheiridion and Fragments. London: George Bell.
  • First published 1848.
• *Long, George. 1991. Enchiridion. Amherst, NY: Prometheus.
  • Reprint of nineteenth-century translation.
• Matheson, P. E. 1916. Epictetus: The Discourses and Manual. 2 vols. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
• *Matson, Wallace I. 1998. Epictetus: Encheiridion. in Louis P. Pojman. ed. Classics of Philosophy: Volume 1, Ancient and Medieval. New York: Oxford University Press.
• *Oldfather, W. A. 1925, 1928. Epictetus: The Discourses as Reported by Arrian, The Manual, and Fragments. 2 vols. Cambridge, MA: Loeb Classical Library, Harvard University Press.
  • With original Greek text facing English translation.
• *Saunders, Jason L. ed. 1996. Greek and Roman Philosophy after Aristotle. New York: Free Press.
  • Readings from Epicureanism, Stoicism, Scepticism, Philo, Plotinus, and early Christian thought. Includes P. E. Matheson’s translation of the Manual of Epictetus.
• *White, Nicholas. 1983. Handbook of Epictetus. Indianapolis: Hackett.
  • A very competent and readable translation, with notes and a helpful, clear introduction.

b. Translations of Hellenistic Philosophers, including the Stoics

• Inwood, Brad and L. P. Gerson. 1997. Hellenistic Philosophy: Introductory Readings. 2nd edition. Indianapolis: Hackett.
  • Readings from the main schools: Epicureanism, Stoicism and Scepticism.
• Long, A. A. and D. N. Sedley. 1987. The Hellenistic Philosophers, Volume 1. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Readings from the main schools: Epicureanism, Stoicism, Scepticism, and the Academics. Includes commentaries on the readings. This is the standard primary source text. Volume 2 contains the original Greek and Latin.

c. Items that Address Epictetus Specifically

• Bonhöffer, Adolf Friedrich. 1996. The Ethics of the Stoic Epictetus. trans. William O. Stephens. New York: Peter Lang.
  • A very nicely done translation of this significant nineteenth-century work first published in 1894.
• Hijmans, B. L. 1959. Askesis: Notes on Epictetus’ Educational System. Assen: Van Gorcum.
• Long, A. A. 2002. Epictetus: A Stoic and Socratic Guide to Life. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Stephens, William O. 1996. Epictetus on How the Stoic Sage Loves. Oxford Studies in Ancient Philosophy 14: 193–210.
  • A very clear, scholarly survey of Epictetus’ ethics.
• Stockdale, James Bond. 1993. Courage Under Fire: Testing Epictetus’s Doctrines in a Laboratory of Human Behavior. Stanford: Hoover Institution/Stanford University.
  • An account of how the author used the principles of Stoic ethics to survive the rigors of a Vietnamese prisoner of war camp.
• Xenakis, Jason. 1969. Epictetus: Philosopher–Therapist. The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff.

d. Items Addressing Stoic Philosophy and/or Hellenistic Ethics Generally

• Annas, Julia. 1995. The Morality of Happiness. New York: Oxford University Press.
• Gould, Josiah B. 1970. The Philosophy of Chrysippus. Albany, NY: State University of New York Press.
• Hadot, Pierre. 1995. Philosophy as a Way of Life. Oxford: Blackwell.
  • Engaging essays on the notion of philosophy as a way of life, with focus on Stoic practice.
• Hadot, Pierre. 1998. The Inner Citadel: The Mediations of Marcus Aurelius. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
  • Contains a very helpful chapter on Epictetus.
• Inwood, Brad. 1985. Ethics and Human Action in Early Stoicism. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
• Lesses, Glen. 1989. Virtue and the Goods of Fortune in Stoic Moral Theory. Oxford Studies in Ancient Philosophy 7: 95–127.
• Lesses, Glen. 1993. Austere Friends: The Stoics and Friendship. Apeiron 26: 57–75.
• Long, A. A. 1986. Hellenistic Philosophy: Stoics, Epicureans, Sceptics. 2nd ed. Berkeley and Los Angeles: University of California Press.
• More, Paul Elmer. 1923. Hellenistic Philosophies. Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
• Nussbaum, Martha C. 1994. The Therapy of Desire: Theory and Practice in Hellenistic Ethics. Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
  • Contains very helpful chapters on Stoic ethics from the view point of philosophy as therapy, as the ancients conceived it.
• Reale, Giovanni. 1990. A History of Ancient Philosophy: 4. The Schools of the Imperial Age. ed. & trans. John R. Catan. Albany, NY: State University of New York Press.
• Sandbach, F. H. 1989. The Stoics. London: Duckworth and Indianapolis: Hackett.
• Sharples, R. W. 1996. Stoics, Epicureans, and Sceptics: An Introduction to Hellenistic Philosophy. London: Routledge.
• Striker, Gisela. 1990. Ataraxia: Happiness as Tranquillity. The Monist 73–1: 97–110. also in Striker 1996
• Striker, Gisela. 1991. Following Nature: A Study in Stoic Ethics. Oxford Studies in Ancient Philosophy 9: 1–73. also in Striker 1996.
• Striker, Gisela. 1996. Essays on Hellenistic Epistemology and Ethics. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.

e. Other items on Hellenistic philosophy generally

• Algra, Keimpe, et al. eds. 1999. The Cambridge History of Hellenistic Philosophy. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Annas, Julia. 1992. Hellenistic Philosophy of Mind. Berkeley and Los Angeles: University of California Press.

Author Information

Keith H. Seddon
Email: k.h.s@btinternet.com
Warnborough College
Ireland

Empedocles (c. 492—432 B.C.E.)

Empedocles (of Acagras in Sicily) was a philosopher and poet: one of the most important of the philosophers working before Socrates (the Presocratics), and a poet of outstanding ability and of great influence upon later poets such as Lucretius. His works On Nature and Purifications (whether they are two poems or only one – see below) exist in more than 150 fragments. He has been regarded variously as a materialist physicist, a shamanic magician, a mystical theologian, a healer, a democratic politician, a living god, and a fraud. To him is attributed the invention of the four-element theory of matter (earth, air, fire, and water), one of the earliest theories of particle physics, put forward seemingly to rescue the phenomenal world from the static monism of Parmenides. Empedocles’ world-view is of a cosmic cycle of eternal change, growth and decay, in which two personified cosmic forces, Love and Strife, engage in an eternal battle for supremacy. In psychology and ethics Empedocles was a follower of Pythagoras, hence a believer in the transmigration of souls, and hence also a vegetarian. He claims to be a daimôn, a divine or potentially divine being, who, having been banished from the immortals gods for ‘three times countless years’ for committing the sin of meat-eating and forced to suffer successive reincarnations in an purificatory journey through the different orders of nature and elements of the cosmos, has now achieved the most perfect of human states and will be reborn as an immortal. He also claims seemingly magical powers including the ability to revive the dead and to control the winds and rains.

Table of Contents

1. Life
2. Works
3. Physics and Cosmology
   1. Physics
   2. Cosmology
4. Biology
   1. Origin of Species
   2. Embryology
   3. Perception and Thought
5. Ethics and the Journey of the Soul
   1. The Daimôns and Transmigration of Souls
   2. Meat-Eating and Sin
   3. Theology
   4. Physics and Theology
6. References and Further Reading
   1. Texts and Commentaries
   2. Studies

1. Life

The most detailed source for Empedocles’ life is Diogenes Laertius’ Lives of the Eminent Philosophers 8.51-75. Perhaps because of his claims to divine status and magical powers a remarkable number of apocryphal stories gathered around the life of Empedocles in antiquity. His death in particular attracted attention and is reported to have occurred in several, clearly bathetic, ways: that he fell overboard from a ship and drowned; that he fell from his carriage, broke his leg and died; that he hanged himself; or the most famous account that, when he felt he was shortly to die and because he wished to appear to have been apotheosized, he leapt into the crater of Etna. In this story the ruse was unfortunately discovered when one of his trademark bronze sandals was thrown up by the volcano.

From more reliable sources it seems that he was born at Acragas in Sicily around 492 B.C.E. and died at the age of sixty. He was the son of a certain Meton, and was from an important and wealthy local aristocratic family: his grandfather, also called Empedocles, is reported to have been victorious in horse-racing at the Olympic Games in 496 B.C.E. It is not known where or with whom he studied philosophy, but various teachers are assigned to him by ancient sources, among them Parmenides, Pythagoras, Xenophanes, Anaxagoras and Anaximander (from whom he is said to have inherited his extravagant mode of dress). Whether or not he was his pupil, Empedocles was certainly very familiar with the work of Parmenides from whom he took the inspiration to write in hexameter verse, and whose physical system he adopts in part, and partly seeks to rectify.

He is reported to have been wealthy and to have kept a train of boy attendants and also to have provided dowries for many girls of Acragas. In dress he affected a purple robe with a golden girdle, bronze sandals, and a Delphic laurel-wreath, and in his manner he was grave and cultivated a regal public persona. These attributes contrast with his political outlook which is uniformly reported to have been actively pro-democratic. He began his political career with the prosecution of two state officials for their arrogant behaviour towards foreign guests which was seen as a sign of incipient tyrannical tendencies. He is also credited with activities against other anti-democratic citizens, and even with putting down an oligarchy and instituting a democracy at Acragas by use of his powers of rhetorical persuasion. Two speeches of his in favour of equality are also mentioned. His surviving poetry certainly shows considerable rhetorical skills, and indeed he is credited by Aristotle with the invention of rhetoric itself. Another report is of his breaking up a shadowy aristocratic political organisation called the ‘Thousand’. As a whole the tradition presents a picture of Empedocles as a popular politician, rhetorician, and champion of democracy and equality. This appears to fit in with the known history of Acragas where after the death of the popular and enlightened tyrant Theron in 473 B.C.E. his son Thrasydaeus proved to be a violent despot. After his forcible removal a democracy was established despite continuing political tensions.

As well as a being a philosopher, poet and politician, Empedocles was famous for his medical skills and healing powers. In his works he presents himself as a wandering healer offering to thousands of eager followers ‘prophecies’ and ‘words of healing for all kinds of illnesses’ (fr. 112 (Fragment numbers are those of Diels-Kranz)). He also promises his addressee Pausanias ‘you will learn remedies (pharmaka) for ills and help against old age’ and even ‘you will lead from Hades the life-force of a dead man’. To what degree this represents the real Empedocles is not known, but a tradition grew up of him as both a renowned physician and a practitioner of more magical cures, or as a charlatan. These stories however, may well derive from Empedocles’ own words in his poetry. On the other hand his work does show considerable interest in biology and especially in embryology and he was eminent enough as a writer on medicine to be attack ed by the writer of the Hippocratic treatise On Ancient Medicine who attempts to separate medicine from philosophy and rejects Empedocles’ work along with all philosophical medical works as irrelevant. The stories of his wonder-working such as curing entire plagues, reviving the dead and controlling the elements are clearly exaggerated at least, but it is becoming clearer, especially since the discovery of the Strasbourg fragments (see below), that, contrary to many former interpretations, Empedocles did not make a clear separation between his philosophy of nature and the more mystical, theological aspects of his philosophy, and so may well have seen no great difference in kind between healing ills through empirical understanding of human physiognomy and healing by means of sacred incantations and ritual purifications. His public as well may have made no great distinction between ‘scientific’ and sacred medicine as is suggested by the account of Empedocles curing a plague by restoring a fresh water-supply, after which he was venerated as a god.

2. Works

Empedocles work survives only in fragments, but luckily in a far greater number than any of the other Presocratics. These fragments are mostly quotations found in other authors such as Aristotle and Plutarch. Although many works, including tragedies and a medical treatise, are attributed to Empedocles by ancient sources no fragments of these have survived, and the extant fragments all come from a work of hexameter poetry traditionally entitled On Nature (Peri Phuseôs) or Physics (Phusika) and some from a possibly separate work called Purifications (Katharmoi). Of these two titles On Nature is by far the better attested and nearly all the fragments which are cited by ancient authors along with the title of the work they came from are attributed to On Nature, while only two are attributed to the Purifications. Because the fragments contain both material that clearly refers to physics and cosmology – the four elements, the cosmic cycle etc. – and also material concerning the fate of the soul, sin and purification, traditionally the former were placed in reconstructions of On Nature, and the latter in the Purifications. Indeed Empedocles’ writings contain ideas and themes that may seem quite incompatible with one another. On Natureas usually reconstructed seemed the work of a mechanist physicist which seeks to replace the traditional gods with four lifeless impersonal elements and two cosmic forces of attraction and repulsion, Love and Strife. The Purifications on the other hand seemed the work of a deeply religious Pythagorean mystic: it was often thought that Empedocles either wrote the Purifications as a move away from the mechanistic materialist position in On Nature, or that the Purifications were an addendum to On Nature, looking at the world from quite a different perspective.

However there have long been doubts about whether there were really two poems or only one poem (perhaps called On Nature and Purifications or with On Nature and Purifications as alternative titles for the same work) which contained both physical and religious material. First, although we may think of a poem called Physics as restricting itself to physical concerns alone, this may well be an anachronistic retrojection of modern rationalistic ideas of a gulf between physics and religion. Further, ancient book titles tend to be generic and there is a long tradition of works called either On Nature (Peri Phuseôs) or Physics (Physika) by various authors, with the earliest attested title for such works being On the Nature of the Universe (Peri Phuseôs tôn Ontôn ‘On the Nature of Things that Exist’), and so neither title may be Empedocles’ own and the two may perhaps be interchangeable different titles for the same work. Although there is still argument on this subject the Strasbourg fragments now suggest strongly that both physical and religious material was originally together in On Nature.

In 1990 the first ancient papyrus fragments of Empedocles were rediscovered at the University of Strasbourg and were published in 1999. Since these were also the first papyrus fragments of any of the Presocratics their discovery caused considerable excitement. Among other important new information they give about Empedocles’ philosophy, with great good fortune fr. a, the longest of the new fragments, was found to be a continuation of the longest of the previously known fragments (fr. 17) and thus now the two together form a continuous text of 69 lines. Fr. 17 is cited by Simplicius as being from book one of On Nature, and again very fortunately Strasbourg fr. a(ii) contains a marginal note by the manuscript copyist identifying line 30 of fr. a(ii) as line 300 of book one of On Nature. Since the Strasbourg fragments seem to have come from a single piece of papyrus, and they also overlap with a formerly known religious fragment usually placed in the Purifications (fr. 1 39) it now seems very likely that Empedocles introduced the themes of sin and purification early on in the physical poem. In fact it can now be argued that all of the fragments of the Purifications can be accommodated in the early part of book one of On Nature.

3. Physics and Cosmology

a. Physics

The foundations of Empedocles’ physics lie in the assumption that there are four ‘elements’ of matter, or ‘roots’ as he calls them, using a botanical metaphor that stresses their creative potential: earth, air, fire and water. These are able to create all things, including all living creatures, by being ‘mixed’ in different combinations and proportions. Each of the elements however, retains its own characteristics in the mixture, and each is eternal and unchanging. The positing of these four roots of matter forms part of a tradition of opposite material creative principles in Presocratic philosophy, but it also has its origins in an attempt to counter the theories of Parmenides who had argued that the world is single and unchanging since nothing can come from nothing and nothing can be destroyed into nothing: the theory known as Eleatic monism. Empedocles’ response was to appropriate Parmenides’ ideas and to use them against themselves. Nothing can come from nothing nor be destroyed into nothing (fr. 12), and therefore, in order to rescue the reality of the phenomenal world, there must be assumed to exist something eternal and unchanging beneath the constant change, growth and decay of the visible world. Empedocles then, transfers the changelessness that Parmenides attributes to the entire world to his four elements, and replaces the static singularity Parmenides’ world with a dynamic plurality. The four elements correspond closely to their expression at the macroscopic level of nature, with the traditional quadripartite division of the cosmos into earth, sea, air, and the fiery aether of the heavenly bodies: these four naturally occurring ‘elements’ of the cosmos clearly represent a fundamental natural division of matter at the largest scale. This division at the macroscopic level of reality is applied reductively at the microscopic level to produce a parallelism between the constituents of matter and the fundamental constituents of the cosmos, but the reduction of the world into four types of material particles does not deny the reality of the world we see, but instead validates it. Empedocles stresses this parallel between the elements at the different levels of reality by using the terms ‘sun’ ‘sea’ and ‘Earth’ interchangeably with ‘fire’, ‘water’ and ‘earth’. Of the four elements, although Empedocles stresses their equality of powers, fire is also granted a special role both in its hardening effect on mixtures of the other elements and also as the fundamental principle of living things.

b. Cosmology

Empedocles also posits two cosmic forces which work upon the elements in both creative and destructive ways. These he personifies as Love (Philia) – a force of attraction and combination – and Strife (Neikos) – a force of repulsion and separation. Whether these cosmic forces are to be envisaged in simply mechanistic terms as descriptions of the way things happen, or as expressions of internal properties of the elements, or as external forces that act upon the elements, is not clear. It is also unclear whether the two forces are to be seen as impersonal mechanistic physical forces or as intelligent divinities that act in purposive ways in creation and destruction. Evidence can be found for all these interpretations. What is clear is that these two forces are engaged in an eternal battle for domination of the cosmos and that they each prevail in turn in an endless cosmic cycle. The details of this cosmic cycle are also difficult to establish, but the most widely accepted interpretation is represented in the following diagram:

Beginning from the top of the diagram and proceeding clockwise, when Love is completely dominant she draws all the elements fully together into a Sphere in which, although the elements are not fused together into a single mass, each is indistinguishable from the others. The Sphere then, is an a-cosmic state during which no matter can exist, and no life is possible. Then as Love’s power gradually weakens and Strife begins to grow in power, he gradually separates out the elements from the Sphere until there is enough separation for matter to come into existence, for the world to be created and for all life to be born. When Strife has achieved total domination we again get an a-cosmic state in which the elements are separated completely and the world and all life is destroyed in a Whirl. Then Love begins to increase in power and to draw the elements together again, and as she does so the world is again created and life is again born. When Love has achieved full dominan ce we return once more to the sphere. As Empedocles puts it in fr. 17.1-8:

A twofold tale I shall tell: at one time it grew to be one only from many, and at another again it divided to be many from one. There is a double birth of what is mortal, and a double passing away; for the uniting of all things brings one generation into being and destroys it, and the other is reared and scattered as they are again being divided. And these things never cease their continuous exchange of position, at one time all coming together into one through Love, at another again being borne away from each other by Strife’s repulsion.

The cosmos exists in a state of constant flux then, beneath which there is a certain sort of stability in the eternity of the elements. The world is in a constant state of organic evolution, and there appear to be two different creations and two different worlds which have no direct link between them. According the most widely accepted interpretation Empedocles considered that we ourselves inhabit the world under the increasing power of Strife.

4. Biology

Empedocles’ physics have a particularly biological focus as is indicated by his choice of the botanical metaphor of ‘roots’ for what were later called ‘elements’. The term ‘roots’ stresses the creative potential of the roots rather than illustrating the way they create things by being mixed in different combinations: ‘elements’ (stoicheia in Greek, elementa in Latin) is the word for the letters of the alphabet, and is a metaphor that stresses the ability of the elements of matter to form different types of matter by interchange of position just as a limited number of letters are able to form all sorts of different words on the page. To illustrate this aspect of the creative abilities of his roots Empedocles uses an analogy with the way painters can use a limited number of colours to create all sorts of different colours and represent all the different productions of nature.
Fr. 23:

As painters, men well taught by wisdom in the practice of their art, decorate temple offerings when they take in their hands pigments of various colours, and after fitting them in close combination – more of some and less of others – they produce from them shapes resembling all things, creating trees and men and women, animals and birds and water-nourished fish, and long-lived gods too, highest in honor; so let not error convince you in your mind that there is any other source for the countless perishables that are seen, but know this clearly, since the account you have heard is divinely revealed.

Among other aspects, this analogy exhibits Empedocles’ tendency to think about the creative abilities of the elements in terms of their biological products, here a characteristically Empedoclean list of creatures representing the different orders of nature: plants, humans, land animals, birds, and fish, as well as gods. If painters use a mixture of a small number of pigments to produce copies of the works of nature, then the same process is productive of those works of nature. In other ways as well in his presentation of the cosmic cycle and the endless combination and separation of the elements he tends to elide the distinction between the elements and the life-forms they produce. Just as in the parallel he draws between the elements of the cosmos on both microscopic and macroscopic levels, so a close parallel is drawn between living creatures and their constituent elements.

a. Origin of Species

Empedocles presents us with the earliest extant attempt at producing a detailed rational mechanism for the origin of species. Greek traditions include the aetiological myths of the origin of a particular species of animal by transformation from a human being (many of these ancient mythological aetiologies are collected by Ovid in the Metamorphoses). The origins of humans, or of particular heroes, founders of cities or of races is frequently explained by what I term a botanical analogy: they originally emerged autochthonously from the ground just as plants do today, and this is also standard in ancient scientific theories as well: the original spontaneous generation of life from the earth, with all creatures emerging in their present species. Empedocles attempts to provide a comprehensive mechanism for the origins not simply of humans or of a particular animal but of all animal life, including humans, and a rational mechanism that would seem to do away with the need for any design in creatures or any external agency to order them and separate them into their individual species.

In Strasbourg fr. a(ii) 23-30 we now find the following lines in which Empedocles seemingly introduces his account of zoogony:

I will show you to your eyes too, where they find a larger body: first the coming together and the unfolding of birth, and as many as are now remaining of this generation. This [is to be seen] among the wilder species of mountain-roaming beasts; this [is to be seen] in the twofold offspring of men, this [is to be seen] in the produce of the root-bearing fields and of the cluster of grapes mounting on the vine. From these convey to your mind unerring proofs of my account: for you will see the coming together and unfolding of birth.

Empedocles promises an exposition of zoogony and the origin of species which, from the examples he gives – wild animals, humans and plants – is clearly intended to encompass all animal and plant life, including humans. He appeals to present day species as proofs of his theories: we can see both the products of this process of zoogony around us in nature today and also, it seems, we can see the same processes still going on today. That the theory refers to present day species rather than creatures in some counter world is underlined by the stress Empedocles puts on ‘as many as are now remaining of this generation’. So the theory is intended to explain the origin and development of all life and refers specifically to the animals and plants around us today, both as examples of and as proofs of the theory he will propose. This process of generation he describes by the repeated ‘the coming together and the unfolding of birth’. This seems to posit two processes which work, either together or separately, to produce the life we see around us today: a process of coming together and also a process of unfolding or perhaps more strictly ‘unleafing’ since the metaphor originates from the leaves of plants. So the second part of this process of zoogony involves a botanical metaphor: just as in the traditional botanical analogy of the myths of autochthony, an appeal to the development and growth of plants is used to describe the process of the development of all life.

According to fragments B57, B59, B60, and B61, first of all individual limbs and organs were produced from the earth. These wandered separately at first and then under the combining power of Love they came together in all sorts of wild and seemingly random hybrid combinations, producing double fronted creatures, hermaphrodites, ox-faced man creatures and man-faced ox-creatures. This weird picture is explained by Aristotle in the Physics and later in more detail by Simplicius in his commentary on the Physics as a theory of the origin of species in which, as we would put it, a certain form of natural selection is operative. The creatures assembled wrongly from parts of disparate animals will die out, either immediately, or by being unable to breed, and only the creatures by chance put together from homogeneous limbs will survive and so go on to found the species that we see today. The production of species and their ordering then is explained by a mechanistic process long recognised as a forerunner of Darwin’s theory of natural selection. Unlike in Darwin’s theory however, there would seem to be no gradual evolution of one species into another, and all of the variety of nature is produced in a great burst of birth in the beginning and is then whittled down by extinctions into the creatures we see today. That this theory intends to account for the origins of both humans and animals is ensured by the component parts of the ox-headed man-creatures and man-headed ox-creatures. There will clearly also be created by this system man-headed man-creatures and ox-headed ox-creatures, that is to say normal oxen and normal humans, although they are not mentioned. Further evidence that this zoogony relates to present day creatures is given by Aristotle and Simplicius who tell us that this process is still going on today.

However, Empedocles also adds to this theory another explanation of the origins of humans very much along the lines of traditional myths of autochthony. In fr. B62 and Strasbourg fr. d he describes the ‘shoots’ of men and women arising from the earth, drawn up by fire as it separates out from the other elements during the creation under the power of increasing Strife. As his choice of the word ‘shoots’ indicates these are not yet fully articulated people with distinct limbs but ‘whole-nature forms’ that ‘did not as yet show the lovely shape of limbs, or voice or language native to man’. We may assume that as Strife increases in power these ‘shoots’ will, just as plant buds do, gradually become fully articulated with distinct limbs and features. So human origins are accounted for by a botanical analogy, with humans as biological productions of the earth itself. This theory is also intended to account for modern-day as humans, as Strasbourg fr. d tells us ‘even now daylight beholds their remains’. So both the creation under Love and the creation under Strife refer to the origins of modern plants, animals, and humans. This is problematic since according to the picture of the cosmic cycle given above the world created by Strife is quite separate from that created by Love, and two quite different explanations are given by Empedocles for each creation of life. Various attempts have been made to account for this, including a radical revision of the cosmic cycle in order to allow both creations of life to take place within the same world, and also seeing the two different worlds of the cosmic cycle as more useful devices for examining different aspects of creation separately than absolutely chronologically separate phases of a cycle: the work of Love in combining creatures and the work of Strife in articulating them would then actually take place at the same time, but are simply described as operative in chronologically separate phases.

b. Embryology

Empedocles is an exponent of the pangenetic theory of embryology. In this theory inheritance of characteristics from both mother and father is explained by each of the two parents’ limbs and organs creating tiny copies of themselves. These miniature limbs and organs then flow together in the generative seed and when the two seeds combine in the womb the father’s seed may provide the model for the nose, while the mother’s seed the model for the eyes and so on. This is an elegant way of accounting for inheritance of characteristics, but this is unlikely to be the whole story. As Aristotle points out there are strong conceptual similarities between Empedocles’ embryology and the creation under Love in which we see the coming together of pre-formed limbs creating life. So Empedocles thinks of the original formation of animals as a process analogous to the present day formation of the embryo in the womb. From his description in Strasbourg fr. a (ii) 23-30 ‘the coming together and unfolding of birth’ we seem to have two processes that are at work in the formation of both present day creatures and the original creation of life. The ‘coming together’ describes both the original coming together of the limbs of the first creatures and also the coming together of the tiny limbs in conception. The other side of the creative process, the ‘unfolding’ is illustrated by the creation under Strife of the ‘shoots of men and pitiable women’ whose limbs are at first not fully articulated or defined: they will undergo a process of ‘unfolding’ just like plant buds and become fully developed humans. This ‘unfolding’ is clearly paralleled in embryology by the gradual development and growth of the embryo in the womb. Therefore it may be best to think of the tiny limbs and organs contained in the generative seed not as fully developed limbs and organs, but as the genetic material that contains the potential for the development of limbs and organs. This is so mewhat speculative, but would provide Empedocles with a much more nearly truly evolutionary theory of the origin of species than had previously been ascribed to him. Certainly the differentiation into the two sexes is described in terms of potential: the warmth of the womb determines whether the embryo will be male or female, cf. fr B 65: ‘They were poured in pure places; some met with cold and became women’, fr. B 67: ‘For the male was warmer . . . this is the reason why men are dark, more powerfully built, and hairier’. It may be that other characteristics are also determined or informed by environmental factors as well.

c. Perception and Thought

Empedocles seems to have been the first philosopher to give a detailed explanation of the mechanism by which we perceive things. His theory, criticised by Aristotle and Theophrastus, is that all things give off effluences and that these enter pores in the sense organs. The pores and the effluences will be of varying shapes and sizes and so only certain effluences enter certain sense-organs if they meet pores of the correct size and shape to admit them. Further, perception is achieved by the attraction of similars: we perceive light colours with fire in the eye, dark colours with water, smell is achieved by the presence of breath in the nostrils etc.

As Theophrastus complains, perception is closely linked to thought by Empedocles, cf. fr. B109:

With earth, we perceive earth, with water water, with air divine fire, with fire destructive fire, with love love, and strife with baneful strife.

fr. B 107:

All things are fitted together and constructed out of these, and by means of them they think and feel pleasure and pain.

In B 109 Empedocles moves from perception of physical elements to ethical perceptions using the same theory of perception by similars, while in B 107 we can see the theory used to account more directly for thought itself. Hence for Empedocles there is a close link between what we perceive and what we think. Further our thoughts will also be affected by our own physical constitutions (B 108). This process of the attraction of like to like is operative from the most fundamental level with the parts of the roots of matter being attracted to their like, right up to the highest level of the purest mixture which is the highest form of thought. Hence it seems that everything in nature has a share in perception and intelligence, cf. fr. 110.10: ‘know that all things have intelligence and a share of thought’.

5. Ethics and the Journey of the Soul

a. The Daimôns and Transmigration of Souls

Plutarch cites the following fragment as coming from ‘the beginning of Empedocles’ philosophy’, fr. B 115:

There is a decree of necessity, ratified long ago by gods, eternal and sealed by broad oaths, that whenever one in error, from fear, defiles his own limbs, having by his error made false the oath he swore – daimôns to whom life long-lasting is apportioned – he wanders from the blessed ones for three-times countless years, being born throughout the time as all kinds of mortal forms, exchanging one hard way of life for another. For the force of air pursues him into the sea, and sea spits him out onto earth’s surface, earth casts him in the rays of blazing sun, and sun into the eddies of air; one takes him from another, and all abhor him. I too am now one of these, an exile from the gods and a wanderer, having put my trust in raving Strife.

Traditionally Plutarch’s seeming attribution of this fragment to On Naturewas assumed to be incorrect and it was placed in the Purifications instead. However from the evidence of the Strasbourg fragments it seems that it may well be that Plutarch was correct, since they contain a description of the details of the sin Empedocles accuses himself of in fr. 115, cf. Strasbourg fr. d lines 5-6:

‘Alas that merciless day did not destroy me sooner, before I devised with my claws terrible deeds for the sake of food’

In fr. 115 Empedocles describes himself as a ‘daimôn’, a being to whom long life has been granted, but who has committed the sin of meat-eating and bloodshed and consequently is punished by banishment from the company of the immortal gods. The banishment lasts three myriads of years, either ‘three-times countless years’ or thirty thousand years. In either case he must atone for his sin by being repeatedly reincarnated into all the different living forms of the different orders of nature. Elsewhere he says: ‘For before now I have been at some time boy and girl, bush, bird, and a mute fish in the sea’ (fr. B 117). Empedocles then, has already suffered this nearly endless cycle of reincarnations having been seemingly hurled down to the lowest rung of the scale of nature but has worked his way up, has been purified at last and, as he tells us in fr. B. 112, is himself now an immortal god. There are others too numbered among the daimôns, those who ‘at the end … come among men on earth as prophets, minstrels, physicians and leaders, and from these they arise as gods, highest in honour.’ (fr. 146). It is not entirely clear whether we are meant to imagine the daimôns as an entirely separate class of blessed being with a different creation and a different fate from ourselves, the ordinary mortals, or as people who began as ordinary mortals but who, having purified themselves and having achieved perfection, are now approaching divine status. The latter reading would perhaps make more sense in terms of Empedocles’ didactic ethical mission: if we are all potentially perfectable, then his purificatory teaching becomes much more crucial. Empedocles himself, as his life shows, has achieved all four of the states that qualify the daimôns for immortality, he is a prophet, a minstrel, a physician and a leader, and can now pass on his wisdom to those on earth whom he is about to leave behind when he rejoins the company of the immortals. As can be seen from the description above, there are strong similarities between Empedocles and the teachings of Pythagoras on the transmigration of souls. Empedocles is clearly a follower of Pythagoras, in his ethics and psychology at least, and shares his vegetarianism and pacifism.

b. Meat-Eating and Sin

Slaughter and meat-eating are the most terrible of sins, indeed for him animal slaughter is murder and meat-eating is cannibalism, as shown by fr. 137:

The father will lift up his dear son in changed form, and blind fool, as he prays he will slay him, and those who take part in the sacrifice bring the victim as he pleads. But the father, deaf to his cries, slays him in his house and prepares an evil feast. In the same way son seizes father, and children their mother, and having bereaved them of life devour the flesh of those they love.

Here, in terms reminiscent of Hesiod’s description of the coming horrors of the Iron Age in Works and Days, we see the appalling consequences of meat-eating: murder, cannibalism, the destruction of whole families and, by extrapolation, of entire societies. This is a radical position in both political and religious terms. Plato’s Protagoras in the eponymous dialogue can simply assume that all men agree that warfare is ‘a fine and noble thing’. For Empedocles warfare, one fundamental plank of the Greek city state, is the most appalling of all evils and is punished by the immortals by hurling the perpetrators not only out of their society, but out of human society and even down to the level of the lowest forms of nature.

c. Theology

In religious terms as well traditional animal sacrifice, another fundamental basis of Greek society, becomes the grossest impiety of all. A probably apocryphal tale reports that Empedocles sacrificed an ox made of honey and meal at Olympia, the religious heart of Greece: a pointed act of criticism of traditional religion. Further evidence for his radical theology lies in his appropriation of the names of the Olympian gods for his roots of matter and his cosmic forces. Implicitly he argues that the Olympian gods came into being as misinterpretations of the natural world: the real ‘gods’ are the elements of nature and the cosmic forces that direct their endless evolutionary cycle. His religious and ethical teachings then are of purification of the soul in an attempt to achieve perfection and unity with perfect Love. He pictures a time in the past, a sort of golden age, when this universal harmony existed, fr. B 128:

They did not have Ares as god or Kydoimos, nor king Zeus, nor Kronos, nor Poseidon but queen Kypris [Love]. Her they propitiated with holy images and painted animal figures, with perfumes of subtle fragrance and offerings of distilled myrrh and sweet-smelling frankincense, and pouring on the earth libations of golden honey. Their altar was not drenched by the unspeakable slaughter of bulls, but this was the greatest defilement among men – to bereave of life and eat noble limbs.

fr. B 130:

All creatures, both animals and birds, were tame and gentle to men, and bright was the flame of their friendship.

Originally people worshipped only one god, Love, and this resulted in universal harmony, even between humans and animals. Implicitly the argument runs that the worship of the Olympian gods he mentions, Ares, Zeus and Poseidon, and the sacrifices they demand have destroyed this harmony, resulting in worship also of Kydoimos, the personification of the noise of battle. Traditional religion with their sacrificial slaughter and meat-eating have had a degrading effect on society.

d. Physics and Theology

As I say above it now seems very likely that Empedocles discussed purificatory topics early on in his poem On Nature. Unlike for modern rationalists then, it seems that for Empedocles there was no fundamental divide between physics and religion. Indeed as can be seen from fr. B 115 above the sin of the daimôn results in an expiatory journey of the soul not only through the different orders of living creatures but through the physical elements of the cosmos. Empedocles draws a close analogy between the cycle of the soul and the cycle of the cosmos itself. This is a hallmark of his work: frequently he uses the same language whether describing the journey of the soul or the cycle of the elements. Sometimes in the Strasbourg fragments the description of the elements coming together under the power of Love is rendered as ‘we are coming together’. His sin, in fr. 115, he describes as resulting from having put his trust in raving Strife, one of his cosmic forces, and conversely in fr. 130 we see the people of the golden age worshipping the other cosmic force, Love. Clearly there is more than a little cross-over between physics and ethics for Empedocles. How this works in detail is hard to pin down but perhaps the best reading we can give of On Natureis that it represents the detailed expression of the cycle of the soul at the level of the entire cosmos. The endless evolutionary cycling of the elements is in fact part of the cycle of the soul.

(Note: all translations are by M. R. Wright except those of the Strasbourg fragments which are by O. Primavesi and A. Martin.)

6. References and Further Reading

a. Texts and Commentaries

• Bollack, J. Empédocle, (Paris, 1965-9), 4 vols. With Greek text, French translation, and commentary.
• Diels, H. and W. Kranz, Die Fragmente der Vorsokratiker (Berlin, 1952), vol. 1, ch. 31, 276-375. Greek text of both fragments (B) and testimonia (A) with German translation.
• Wright, M. R. (2nd edn.), Empedocles the Extant Fragments (London, 1995). With Greek text, English translation, introduction and commentary.
• Inwood, B. The Poem of Empedocles (Toronto, 1992). With Greek text, facing English translation and introduction.
• Martin, A. and O. Primavesi, L’Empédocle de Strasbourg: (P. Strasb. gr. Inv. 1665-1666) (Berlin/Strasbourg, 1998). With Greek text, French and English translations, introduction, commentary, and English summary.

b. Studies

• Gemelli Marciano, L. “Le ‘demonologie’ empedoclee: problemi di metodo e altro”, Aevum Antiquum 1 (2003), 205-35
• Gemelli Marciano, L. Le metamorfosi della tradizione: mutamenti de significato e neologismi nel Peri physeos di Empedocle (Bari, 1999).
• Guthrie, W.K.C. A History of Greek Philosophy vol. 2 (Cambridge 1969), ch. 3
• Kingsley, P. Ancient Philosophy, Mystery and Magic: Empedocles and Pythagorean Tradition (Oxford, 1995)
• Kirk, G. S. and J.E. Raven, M. Schofield, (2nd edn.), The Presocratic Philosophers (Cambridge 1983), ch. 10.
• O’Brien, D. Empedocles’ Cosmic Cycle (Cambridge, 1969)
• Osborne, C. ‘Empedocles recycled’, Classical Quarterly NS 37 (1987), 24-50
• Osbourne, C. ‘Rummaging in the recycling bins of Upper Egypt: a discussion of A. Martin and O. Primavesi, ZL’ Empédocle de Strasbourg’, Oxford Studies in Ancient Philosophy 18 (Oxford, 2000), 329-56.
• Sedley, D. N. ‘Empedocles’ life cycles’, in Proceedings of the Symposium Tertium Mykonense (forthcoming, 2004)
• Solmsen, F. ‘Love and Strife in Empedocles’ cosmology’, Phronesis 10 (1965), 123-45; repr. in R.E. Allen and D.J. Furley (eds), Studies in Presocratic Philosophy, (London, 1975), vol. 2, 221-64.
• Trépanier, S. ‘Empedocles on the ultimate symmetry of the world’, Oxford Studies in Ancient Philosophy 24 (2003), 1-57
• Trépanier, S. Empedocles: An Interpretation (London, 2004)

Author Information

Gordon Campbell
Email: gordon.l.campbell@may.ie
National University of Ireland, Maynooth
Ireland

Galen (130—200 C.E.)

Galen was one of the most prominent ancient physicians as well as a philosopher (though most of his philosophical writings are lost). Nonetheless, his philosophical interests are quite evident in his practice of biological science. Galen made some key anatomical observations (though most of these were on other primates).  However, this inclination toward observation moved his theory into the class of critical empiricism.

Galen was also a well-read scholar who combined extensive erudition with ‘cutting edge’ observational practice to completely change the understanding and teaching of medicine. He frequently integrates his observational practice with the natural philosophy of Plato and Aristotle.  His position as the leading authority in medical theory extended for at least fourteen hundred years.

Galen correctly saw that there is a methodological difference between taking account of the patient in front of you in all of the patient’s particularity and, instead, understanding the patient in front of you as representing an instance of a general rule of biomedical science. The way that Galen sought to insert himself into this debate makes his conclusions relevant to medicine today.

 

Table of Contents

1. Life
2. Hellenistic Schools of Medicine
3. Method
4. Galen’s Critical Empiricism
5. References and Further Reading

1. Life

Galen of Pergamum was a physician who was born in Pergamum was a bustling and vibrant city at the time and was particularly famous for its statue of Asclepius, a god of healing. Throughout Galen’s life, he avowed a devotion to Asclepius. The city also had a library that almost rivaled Alexandria’s in its size. Galen’s father, Nicon, was a prosperous architect. This allowed Galen the leisure to get an education and choose a path of life unencumbered by the need to earn money. However, this affluence did not mean that Galen was brought up “soft” (as per Plato’s discussion in the Republic 544b-570e in which he discusses the devolution of political systems due to the decay of personal arête). Galen’s education was broad and directed by his father. Galen studied in mathematics (a particular favorite of his father), grammar, logic, and philosophy–that included inquiry into the four major schools of the time: the Platonists, the Peripatetics, the Stoics, and the Epicureans. This pluralistic sensibility influenced the philosophical/scientific method of Galen. According to pluralism, one should look at all the prevalent theories and then make up one’s own mind choosing either one of the theories or perhaps a new mixture of those presented according to their strengths.

Galen began his study of medicine around the age of sixteen when his father had a dream suggesting this direction. Galen traveled to Smyrna and Corinth to study with both a Rationalist and with an Empiricist. When Galen’s father died, Galen traveled to Egypt (Alexandria) where he lived for perhaps five years (152-157). What Galen might have studied in Alexandria is highly speculative. However, Galen, himself, later declares that students should “look at the human skeleton with your own eyes. This is very easy in Alexandria, so that the physicians of that area instruct their pupils with the aid of autopsy” (Kühn II, 220, translation L. Edelstein). This quotation points to the practice of autopsy (dissection of cadavers) in Alexandria. Whether Galen also studied anatomy this way is unclear. It is clear that Galen (at least) engaged in comparative anatomy by dissecting monkeys.

In 157 Galen returned to his hometown to become a surgeon to the gladiators. When civil unrest broke out in 162, Galen left for Rome. The medical community in Rome was competitive and corrupt. In Rome, Galen’s ambition got the best of him with the result that his high profile created powerful enemies who caused him to depart secretly in 166. After a couple of years in obscurity, Galen was recalled by the Roman Emperors Marcus Aurelius and Lucius Verus to serve the army in their war against the Germans. When the plague hit Rome, Galen was made personal physician to Marcus Aurelius and Aurelius’ son, Commodus. For many years it has been held that Galen remained in Roman society until his death around 199-200 (based upon the Suda Lexicon written around 1000); however, new research by Vivian Nutton has persuasively set the date of Galen’s death much later. Nutton proposes that Galen may have lived into his eighties (possibly as old as 87). The source for this new information comes from Byzantine and Arab scholars from the sixth century onwards. On the basis of this, it seems that Galen died around 216, give or take several years, in the reign of Caracalla.

A great many of Galen’s works have survived. The Kühn edition of Galen (Greek with a Latin translation) runs over 20,000 pages. There are other Galenic works that only exist in Arabic translations. However, many of Galen’s works are lost, e.g., many of his treatises on philosophy (logic, physics, and ethics) perished in a fire that consumed the Temple of Peace in 191.

2. Hellenistic Schools of Medicine

During the end of the fourth century BCE and throughout the third century BCE there were enormous advances in medicine revolving around the principal practitioners: Diocles, Praxagoras, Herophilus, and Erasistratus. During this period the debate about the relative roles of theory and observation were central to these writers (Kühn X, 107). It is, in fact, a perennial question in the philosophy of science. What is at issue is when does one impose a theoretical structure on the world? Part of the answer concerns the origins of the theoretical structure. From whence did it arise? In part, this is a struggle for a logic of induction that might assist the practitioner. Without such a theory of inductive logic, it is unclear whether nature is revealing her nature to the careful observer or whether the observer is imposing his own ideas upon nature. Aristotle discusses some of these issues in Posterior Analytics II.19 and in The Parts of Animals I. However, this is not the end of the question. Some of this tension can be seen in the biomedical writers in the Hippocratic era. However, it is also true that in the construction of scientific theories there must, of necessity, be a tension between those who embrace theoretical structures and those who are skeptical of them. The latter group generally bases their misgivings upon a possible tendency among theorists to create an a priori science. What makes a priori science troublesome is that it breaks contact with the empirical world. It suggests that ratiocination about natural causes is sufficient for the production of scientific theories. For most natural philosophers such a stance is entirely unacceptable. Setting the proper balance between theory and observation was (and continues to me) an important question in the philosophy of science.

One group that added to the debate on the role of observation were the Empiricists. The origins of the Empiricist School might be found in Acron of Akragas, a fifth century BCE follower of Empedocles. This conjecture is based merely upon the testimony of later writers. It could certainly be the case that there was no real medical empiricism, as such, before Serapion, a third century BCE doctor .

Another interesting speculation on the origins of the empiricist physicians comes from Michael Frede. Frede has suggested that from a reference in Plato’s Laws 720a-c; 857c-d that there was a two-tired medical system with physicians for the wealthy (who employed theoretical principles) and physicians for the slaves (who relied merely upon trial-and-error experience). If this speculation is correct, then the burden of proof for the empiricists is to show that the theoretical “book learning” of upper class doctors could be reduced to mere experience. In other words, experience, itself, could generate competence. The result would be an elevation of the second-level physician. If Frede is correct on this, then perhaps social situation is partially responsible for the rise of the medical empiricists.

Sextus Empiricus (circa 160-210) set out a loosely woven doctrine of “consideration” or skepsis. Sextus is a key source of our knowledge of Pyrrhonism and is also said to have been a physician (though his writings on medicine have not survived). It is not clear whether Sextus was an original thinker or merely a reflection of his era. However, at the very least, one can garner background information of what might have influenced the empiricists through the doctrine of skepsis. Under this doctrine the theoretical structures of the philosophers (Dogmatists) would be held in abeyance (neither accepted nor rejected). What would rule the day would be the case before the physician right now. The case and the physician’s experience would dictate the treatment.

Against the Empiricists, on the other hand, were the philosophers (Dogmatists). In one important way the Dogmatists are not a “school” as such. They are often depicted by their detractors, such as the Empiricists, rather than being self-identifying. This may relate to the social class dynamics noted earlier. Thus, one should keep in mind that the group is not so much a school of practitioners but a depiction of a group by objectors to those who profess a foundation in medical theory. Perhaps the best way to characterize the Dogmatists would be on the issue of aetiology. The Empiricists attacked the Dogmatists for asserting that there might be hidden causes of disease, and that these hidden causes might be grasped via ratiocination. This was because (under this characterization) the Dogmatists were advocating reasoning and conjecture over experience. To the Empiricists, this was akin to creating a priori science.

The Dogmatists (even in this quasi-class depiction) were identified with one of the four prominent philosophical schools (Platonists, Aristotelians/Peripatetics, Stoics, and Epicureans). Detractors said that the Dogmatists honored theory over observation and experience. Of course, from the point of view of the philosophical schools, rational theories create a critical structure that aid in the interpretation and explanation of nature. The sense of explanation here harkens back to Aristotle, who distinguished knowing the fact (hoti) and the reasoned fact (dioti, APo II, i). It may not be enough to know that if I (as a physician) do x, then y will result (anecdotal correlation of two events). That sort of hoti (or merely event + consequence unit) is insufficient. The reason for this is that when circumstances alter slightly, how is the practitioner to know whether this alteration is significant unless he also has an appreciation of the mechanism that underlies the process? For example, anecdotal correlation might (in a non-medical modern example) suggest that every time I wash my car, it will rain. My personal experience may be almost perfect, but that does not mean that such a causal connection actually exists. The reluctance to embrace a non-observable causal mechanism leaves this dilemma to those who profess an aversion to theory in favor of experience.

Somewhat in the middle of these two schools were the Methodists. Aside from Soranus there are no surviving texts of the Methodists. Therefore most of what we have comes from the descriptions of Galen and pseudo-Galen on these writers. The following are cited as being Methodists: Thessalos, Themison, Proklos, Reginos, Antipatros, Eudemos, Mnaseas, Philon, Dionysios, Menemachos, Olympikos, Apollonides, Soranus, Julianus (Kühn X, 52-53, XIV, 684). There is some controversy about the characterization and origins of this school but many relate it to Themison of Laodicea a pupil of Asclepiades of Bithynia. However this attribution is disputed by Celsus and Soranus who state that Themison is not the first but merely a representative of Methodism. At any rate, the Methodists paid attention (in contrast to the Dogmatists and Empiricists) to the disease alone as opposed to the situation of the individual patient, that is, his medical history and personal situation. The disease alone dictates treatment (Kühn III, 14-20). Thus, the physician does not have to have anatomical or physiological knowledge of the body. Instead, he observes the body in a holistic manner (koinotetes). The three principle conditions of a body viewed in this way are: (a) the body’s dryness, (b) the body’s fluidity, and (c) the mixture of the two. The “method” to be followed was to follow the phenomena. Underlying this assumption was the notion about the status of pores in the mechanism of the body’s common balance. The body’s pores allowed atoms to enter and exit the body. When the atoms came and went freely health was the result. When there was a disruption, then sickness was the result. When the pores were either too small (constriction) or too large (dilatation) then an imbalance occurred in the normal atomic flow. Atoms are invisible to the naked eye. Pores are visible, but their subtle alterations are often not visibly detectable. Thus, on the face of it, the Methodists seem to be contra-Empiricist. However, the atomist tradition (upon which this theory rests) was taken to be Empiricist. (In principle, one could view an entirely physical event-if it were possible to witness it.) Thus, the Methodists seem to have affinities to both. This is evident in Themison (first century, BCE) and Thessalus (first century, AD). Disease was depicted as a community of constriction or dilatation (or some combination of the two) that, in principle, was observable even though, in practice, it couldn’t be observed except through its effects, namely, the disease. Thus, though the intent of the Methodists was probably to lean toward the Empiricists, the actual practice put them more in-between.

Galen often characterizes himself as an eclectic belonging to no school. It is true that Galen was an innovator in observation, for example he gave the first depiction of the four-chambered human heart. But his epistemology was grounded in his philosophical training. Over and over Galen relies on an over-arching medical theory to drive his aetiology (Kühn X, 123, 159, 246). In this way his practice is closest to Aristotelian critical empiricism that requires careful observation and a comprehensive theory that will make those observations meaningful.

3. Method

Because of Galen’s pluralistic method, it is appropriate that (for the most part) his own method draws upon his predecessors with additions and corrections. For example, Galen employed the four-element theory (earth, air, fire, and water) as well as the theories of the contraries (hot, cold, wet, and dry). Though Aristotle interrelated these two descriptive accounts in his work Generation and Corruption, it is Galen who attempts to create a more gradated form by making quasi-quantitative categories of the contraries to describe the material composition of the mixtures (On Mixtures). From the perspective of modern science, this is an advancement upon Aristotle. This work on mixtures is also used to account for the properties of drugs (On Simples). Drugs were supposed to counteract the disposition of the body. Thus, if a patient were suffering from cold and wet (upper respiratory infection), then the appropriate drug would be one that is hot and dry (such as certain molds and fungi-does this remind you of penicillin?). The use of broad-reaching natural principles enhanced the explanatory power of Galen’s theory of biological science.

Galen speaks at length about the philosophers Plato (from whom he accepts the tri-partite soul) and Aristotle (whose biological works are well known to him). In medicine, he is also greatly influenced by historical figures such as Hippocrates (who he describes as a single individual opposed to our modern understanding of a group of writers-even though Galen was aware of the Hippocratic Question), Herophilus, and especially Erasistratus. In his avowed work on biological theory, On the Natural Faculties, Galen goes to great lengths to refute the principles of Erasistratus and his followers.

Contemporary figures are also discussed such as Aclepiades, and the Methodists Themison and Thessalus. This thorough use of the context of medicine allows Galen to consider, for example, Eristrates’ theory of mechanical digestion via a vacuum principle and to supplant it with his own theory of attraction (holke). Galen’s theory of attraction may have had its roots in the theory of natural place that always lacked a material force to implement it. At any rate, when the mechanisms are inscrutable, it was important for Galen to offer an account that fits into other parts of his theory (such as the mixture of the contraries in the composition of the elements).

One of the most influential aspects of Galenic practice was his implementation of (or invention of-as per Wesley Smith) the Hippocratic theory of the four humours (phlegm, blood, black bile, and yellow bile). These points of focus relate to a theory of health as balance. Each of these four humours is related to the three principal points of the body: head (phlegm), heart (blood), black bile (liver) and yellow bile (the liver’s complement, the gall bladder). The three principal points of the body are also loosely linked to the Platonic tripartite soul: head (sophia, reason), heart (thumos, emotion or spiritedness), liver (epithumos, desire). Thus, the sort of just balance of the soul that Plato argues for in the Republic is also the ground of natural health. When one part of the soul/body is out of balance, then the individual becomes ill. The physician’s job is to assist the patient in maintaining balance. If a person is too full of uncontrollable emotion or spiritedness, for example, then he is suffering from too much blood. The obvious answer is to engage in bloodletting (guaranteed to calm a person down). As in the case of pharmacology and the contraries, the four humours provide a comprehensive account of what it means to obtain and maintain health via the balancing of various primary principles.

4. Galen’s Critical Empiricism

One of the striking features of ancient medicine is the extent that very limited observations had to be interpreted in order to explain natural function. For example, given that blood was considered to be nourishment, trophe, it seemed reasonable (following Aristotle) that the blood would be entirely consumed by the body’s tissue. Thus, the blood would be manufactured in the liver and heart and then would flow to the rest of the body and be consumed. The flow of blood went one-way. However, there was a problem: there were two sorts of blood vessels (veins and arteries). These were structurally distinct. This was known through dissection of primates. Then it is assumed that Nature does nothing in vain (discussed at length in On the Use of the Parts as a key biomedical explanatory principle). This means that the veins and arteries have different functions. But they cannot be too disparate. The answer to this dilemma for Galen is that the arteries carry blood mixed with aer or pneuma that acts as a vital force whereas the venous blood is ordinary-though Galen held (correctly) that the two systems were connected by tiny almost invisible vessels (capillaries).

Thus Galen began with a problem and a number of observations and sought to make sense of the seeming anomalies via his overarching biomedical principles. In this way, Galen was acting according to the mathematical training from his father and a desire to create a unified (quasi-axiomatic) explanatory system. Without observation, this could have led to a priori or “armchair” science. But when combined with careful observation, it leads to critical empiricism.

Another example of this mixture of observation and inference is in the area of conception theory. Galen says in his treatise, On Seed,

These things have been said by me because of some of the philosophers who call themselves Aristotelians and Peripatetics. I, at least, would not address these men so, they being so greatly ignorant of the opinion of Aristotle that they think it is pleasing to him that the sperm of the male being cast into the uterus of the female places the principle of motion in the katamenia (the female seed) and, after this is expelled, the principle of motion in the katamenia and, after it is expelled, does not any part become the corporeal substance of the fetus. They have been deceived by the first book of the Generation of Animals that alone of the five they seem to have read. These things are written there, “As we said, of the generation of the principles we may say that chiefly there are the male principle and the female principle. The male offers the motive principle and the efficient cause of generation while the female offers the material principle” [Galen quoting Aristotle, G.A. 716a 5].

These are not far after the beginning: in still later parts of the tract he writes as well, “But this may be well concluded that the male provides the form and the principle of motion and the female provides the body and the matter just as the example of curding milk. Here the body is the milk and the fig juice contains the principle that makes it curdle” [Galen quoting Aristotle, G.A. 729a 10; Kühn IV, 516-517, my tr.].

The biological accounts of human reproduction in the ancient world offer excellent examples of the interaction between observation and inference. There are a number of issues involved in this issue that pre-dates even the Hippocratic writers. The one that is mentioned here is the issue of whether there is one seed (the male’s only) or two (the male’s and the female’s). In the above example Galen seems to be saying that the first reading of Aristotle in which the male provides the efficient cause and the female provides the material cause, simpliciter, is a misreading of Aristotle. Instead, the event (conception) is depicted as a more involved process in which principles of both parents come into play. These principles revolve around the empirically observable facts that children as often as not resemble the mother as much as the father. The “one seed” theory in which the father’s seed, alone, fashions the child can only account for such an outcome by calling it a sort of mutation (agone, para physin). But regularity counts for something. It is odd when an event that may approach or exceed 50% is called a mutation. This turns the entire idea of mutation (a statistical anomaly) on its head.

Galen approaches the issue with a balanced approach beginning with anatomical observations. Galen did some of the most extensive work in the ancient world on the study of the female anatomy (albeit mostly upon apes, On Anatomical Procedures, I.2). Galen’s observation of a fluid in the horns of the uterus (Kühn IV, 594, 600-601) were the basis of his (mistaken) view that he had discovered female seed. However, in the midst of this mistake he was on the right track in viewing the ovaries as analogous to the male testes.

The point in this second example is that Galen wanted to combine his observations gained in dissections of apes to his pronouncements vis-à-vis the debate concerning “one seed conception” vs. “two seed conception.” This commitment to integrating observation and theory contributed to making Galen a towering figure in medicine and the philosophy of science.

5. Select Bibliography

Primary Texts

• Galeni Opera Omnia. Basel: Par’Andrea to Kratandro, 1538.Kühn, C.G. Galeni Opera Omnia. Leipzig: C. Cnobloch, 1821-1833, rpt. Hildesheim, 1965.
  • This is still the standard edition though it is very gradually being supplanted by the Corpus Medicorum Graecorum Leipzig, 1914-present.

Key Texts in Translation

• Abhandlung darüber, dass der vorzügliche Arzt Philosoph sein muss. [Quod optimus medicus sit idem philosophus] translated by Peter Bachmann. Göttingen: Vanderhoeck & Ruprecht, 1996.L’Áme et ses passions: Les passions et les erreurs de l’áme. Translated and notes by Vincent Barras. Paris: Les Belle Lettres, 1995.
• Galen on Antecedent Causes. Edited and translated with introduction and commentary by R.J. Hankinson. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1998.
• Galen on Bloodletting. Translated by Peter Brain. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1986.
• Galen on Food and Diet. Translated and notes by Mark Grant. London: Routledge, 2000.
• Galen’s Institutio logica. Translated with commentary by John Spangler Kieffer. Baltimore: Johns Hopkins University Press, 1964.
• Galen on Language and Ambiguity (De captionibus). Translated with commentary by Robert Blair Edlow. Leiden: Brill, 1977.
• Galen on the Natural Faculties. Translated by Arthur John Brock. London: Heineiman, Ltd., 1952. Loeb series.
• Galen on the Usefulness of the Parts of the Body {De usu partium). Translated with commentary by Margaret Tallmadge May. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press, 1968.
• Galen, The Therapeutic Method: Books 1 & 2 (De methodo medendi). Edited and translated by R.J. Hankinson. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1991.

Selected Secondary Sources

• Barnes, Jonathan. “A Third Sort of Syllogism: Galen and the Logic of Relations” in Modern Thinkers and Ancient Thinkers. R. W. Sharples, ed. Boulder, CO: Westview Press, 1993.Boylan, Michael. “Galen’s Conception Theory” Journal of the History of Biology 19.1 (1986): 44-77.
• Boudon-Millot, ed, fr. tr. Introduction génerale; sur ses propres livres que l’excellent médecin devienne philosophe. Paris: Les Belles Lettres, 2007.
• Boudon-Millot, And Alessia Guardasole, and Caroline Magdelaine, eds. La science médicale antique: nouveaux regards: etudes reunites en l’honneur de Jacques Jouanna. Paris: Beauchesne, 2007.
• Boylan, Michael. “Galen on the Blood, Pulse, and Arteries” Journal of the History of Biology 40.2 (2007): 207-230.
• Boylan, Michael. “The Hippocratic and Galenic Challenges to Aristotle’s Conception Theory” Journal of the History of Biology 15.1 (1984): 83-112.
• Connell, Sophia. “Aristotle and Galen on Sex Difference and Reproduction: A New Approach to an Ancient Rivalry.” Studies in History and the Philosophy of Science. 31-a.3(2000):405-427.
• Cosans, Christopher E. “The Experimental Foundations of Galen’s Teleology” Studies in History and Philosophy of Science. 29A.1 (1998): 63-90.
• Crombie, A. C. Augustine to Galileo. Vol. 1. London: Heinemann, 1961.
• DeLacy, Philip. “Galen’s Platonism” American Journal of Philology. 93 (1972): 27-39.
• Durling, Richard. A Dictionary of Medical Terms. Leiden: Brill, 1993.
• Edelstein, Ludwig. Ancient Medicine. Baltimore, MD: Johns Hopkins University Press, 1967.
• Farrington, B. Greek Science: Theophrastus to Galen. Baltimore, MD: Penguin, 1953.
• Fischer, Klaus-Dietrich ed., Text and Tradition: Studies in Ancient Greek Medicine and its Transmission: Presented to Jutta Kollesch Leiden: Brill, 1998.
• Frede, Michael. “The Empiricist Attitude toward Reason and Theory” Apeiron. 21 (1988): 79-97.
• Freudiger, Jurg. “Methodus resolutiva: Antikes und Neuzeitliches in Jacopo Acontios Methodenschrift” Freiburger Zeitschrift für Philosophie und Theologie. 45.3 (1998): 407-446.
• Gill, Christopher. “Galen vs. Chrysippus on the Tripartite Psyche in ‘Timaeus’ 69-72” in Interpreting the ‘Timaeus-Critias. Tomas Calvo ed. Sankt Augustin: Academia: 1997.
• Gill, Christopher. “Did Chrysippus Understand Medea?” Phronesis. 28.2 (1983): 136-149.
• Hankinson, R. J. “Actions and Passions” in Passions and Perceptions. Martha Nussbaum, ed. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1993.
• Hankinson, R.J. The Cambridge Companion to Galen. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2008.
• Hankinson, R. J. “Galen’s Anatomy of the Soul” Phronesis 36.3 (1991): 197-233.
• Hankinson, R. J. “A Purely Verbal Dispute? Galen on Stoic and Academic Epistemology” Revue Internationale de Philosophie. 45.178 (1991): 267-300.
• Hankinson, R. J. “Evidence, Externality and Antecendence: Inquiries Into Later Greek Causal Concepts.” Phronesis 32.1 (1987): 80-100.
• Hankinson, R. J. “Causes and Empiricism: A Problem in the Interpretation of Later Greek Medical Method.” Phronesis 32.4 (1987): 329-348.
• Kagan, Jerome, Nancy Snidman, Doreen Ardus, J. Steven Rezinck. Galen’s Prophecy: Temperament in Human Nature. NY: Basic Books, 1994.
• Kember, O. “Right and Left in the Sexual Theories of Parmenides” Journal of Hellenic Studies. 91 (1971): 70-79.
• Kidd, I. G. “Posidonius on Emotions” in Problems in Stoicism. A. A. Long, ed. London: Athlone, 1971.
• Kollesch, Jutta. Galen über das Riechorgan. Berlin: Akademie-Verlag, 1964.
• Kollesch, Jutta and Diethard Nickel, eds. Galen und das hellenistische Erbe. Stuttgart: Franz Steiner, 1993.
• Kudlien, Fridolf and Richard J. Durling. Galen’s Method of Healing. Leiden: E.J. Brill, 1991.
• Lloyd, G.E.R. Methods and Problems in Greek Science. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1991.
• Lloyd, G.E.R. Greek Science After Aristotle. New York: Norton, 1973.
• Lloyd, G.E.R. “Parmenides’ Sexual Theories: A Reply to MER Kember” Journal of Hellenic Studies. 92 (1972): 178-179.
• Lumpe, Adolf. “Der logische Grundgedanke der vierten Schlussfigur.” Prima Philosophia. 11.4 (1998): 397-404.
• Lumpe, Adolf. “Zur Anordnung der Pramissen des kategorischen Syllogismus bei Albinos, Galenus und Pseudo-Apuleius” Prima Philosophia 8.2 (1995): 115-124.
• Mansfield, Jaap. “The Idea of the Will in Chrysippus, Posidonius, and Galen” Proceedings of the Boston Area Colloquium in Ancient Philosophy 7 (1991): 107-145.
• Manuli, Paola. “Galien et le Stoicisme” Revue de Mataphysique et de Morale 97.3 (1992): 365-375.
• Mowry, Bryan. “From Galen’s Theory to William Harvey’s Theory: A Case Study in the Rationality of Scientific Theory Change” Studies in History and the Philosophy of Science 16 (1985): 49-82.
• Nutton, Vivian. Ancient Medicine. London: Routledge, 2004.
• Nutton, Vivian. “The Chronology of Galen’s Early Career” Classical Quarterly 23 (1973): 158-171.
• Nutton, Vivian. (ed.) Galen: Problems and Prospects. London: Wellcome Institute, 1981.
• Nutton, Vivian. “Galen ad multos annos” Dynamis 15 (1995): 25-39.
• Rescher, Nicholas. Galen and the Syllogism: An Examination of the Thesis that Galen Originated the Fourth Figure of the Syllogism in Light of New Data from the Arabic. Pittsburgh, PA: University of Pittsburgh Press, 1996.
• Sarton, George. Galen of Pergamon. Lawrence, KS: University of Kansas Press, 1954.
• Siegel, Rudolph. Galen’s System of Physiology and Medicine. Basel: Karger, 1968.
• Smith, Wesley. The Hippocratic Tradition. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press, 1979.
• Temkin, Owsei. Galenism: The Rise and Decline of a Medical Philosophy. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press, 1973.
• Tieleman, Teun. “Plotinus on the Seat of the Soul: Reverberations of Galen and Alexander in Enn. IV, 3 27ESS, 23.” Phronesis. 43.4 (1998): 306-325.

Select Proceedings of Conferences on Galen

1981 English

• Nutton, Vivian, Galen : Problems and Prospects. London: Wellcome Institute for the History of Medicine, 1981.

1982 English

• Kudlien, F., & Durling, R. J. Galen’s method of healing : Proceedings of the 1982 Galen Symposium. Paper presented at the Galen Symposium (1982 : Christian-Albrechts Universität); Studies in Ancient Medicine,; v. 1, 205. Leiden: Brill, 1991.

1986 3rd Italian

• Manuli, P., & Vegretti, M. (1988). Le Opere Psicologiche di Galeno : Atti del terzo Colloquio Galenico Internazionale, Pavia, 10-12 Settembre 1986. Paper presented at the Colloqio Galenico Internazionale (3d : 1986 : Pavia, Italy); Elenchos (Bibliopolis (Firm)) 13,

1989 4th German

• Kollesch, J., Nickel, D., Humboldt-Universität zu Berlin, & Institut für Geschichte der Medizin. (1993). Galen und das Hellenistische Erbe : Verhandlungen des IV. Internationalen Galen-Symposiums veranstaltet vom Institut für Geschichte der Medizin am Bereich Medizin (charité) der Humboldt-Universität zu Berlin 18.-20. September 1989. Paper presented at the Galen Symposium (4th : 1989 : Humboldt-Universität Zu Berlin); Sudhoffs Archiv.; Beihefte,; Heft 32,

1995 5th English

• Debru, A. (1997). Galen on Pharmacology : Philosophy, history, and medicine : Proceedings of the Vth International Galen Colloquium, Lille, 16-18 March 1995. Paper presented at the International Galen Colloquium (5th : 1995 : Lille, France); Studies in Ancient Medicine,; v. 16, 336. Leiden: Brill, 2007.

1988 Spanish

• López Férez, J. A. (1991). Galeno, obra, pensamiento e influencia : Coloquio internacional celebrado en Madrid, 22-25 de marzo de 1988. Madrid : Universidad Nacional de Educación a Distancia, 1991.

2002 Italian

• Garofalo, I., Roselli, A., Fischer, K., Galen, On the therapeutic method, & Book III. (2003). Galenismo e Medicina Tardoantica : Fonti greche, latine e arabe : Atti del Seminario Internazionale di Siena, Certosa di Pontignano, 9 e 10 Settembre 2002. Paper presented at the Annali Dell’Istituto Universitario Orientale Di Napoli.; Sezione Filologico-Letteraria.; Quaderni,; 7,

2002 English

• Nutton, Vivian. The Unknown Galen. London : Institute of Classical Studies, School of Advanced Study, University of London, 2002.

Author Information

Michael Boylan
Email: michael.boylan@marymount.edu
Marymount University
U. S. A.

Hippocrates (c. 450—c. 380 B.C.E.)

Hippocrates of Cos was said to have lived sometime between 450 BCE to 380 BCE. He was a physician, and the writings of the Corpus Hippocraticum provide a wealth of information on biomedical methodology and offer one of the first reflective codes of professional ethics. Though Plato (a contemporary) makes reference to Hippocrates (Phaedrus 270a and elsewhere), it is generally believed that most of the writings in the Corpus Hippocraticum are actually the work of a number of different writers. By convention of time, place and general approach a common name of ‘Hippocrates’ was assigned to the lot (without distinguishing those of the historical Hippocrates). Hippocrates and the other associated writers provide the modern student with a number of different sorts of insights.

On the biomedical methodology side, these writings provide the most detailed biomedical observations to date in the Western world. They also offer causal speculations that can be knitted together to form a theoretical framework for diagnosis and treatment. On the ethical side, their code of professional ethics is so well structured that it continues to stand as a model for other professions.

Table of Contents

1. Biomedical Methodology
   1. The Four Humors
   2. An Ancient Debate: Are General Causal Theories Beneficial?
   3. Prognosis and Treatment
   4. The Hippocratic Writings and Hellenistic Medicine
2. Ethics
   1. The Oath
   2. The Oath and Modern Codes of Conduct
3. References and Further Reading
   1. Primary Sources
   2. Secondary Sources
   3. Published Conferences on Hippocrates

1. Biomedical Methodology

One way to parse the groups of Hippocratic writers revolves around their geographical origins: Cos vs. Cnidos. Though this classification is controversial, it is useful (whether one accepts the literal geographical demarcation) to mark some clear distinctions in the Hippocratic body of writing. It appears to be the case that the Cos writers sought to create general biomedical “laws” that for the most part would give the explanation for why someone was sick. Any physician might make reference to these “laws” and thereby have an etiology for the disease, and by extension a strategy for treatment.

a. The Four Humors

The most historically prominent theoretical scheme of the Coan writers was the doctrine of the four humors of the body: blood, phlegm, black bile, and yellow bile (or sometimes serum). Health was defined as the balance of the four humors. Disease was defined as the imbalance of the humors. When imbalance occurred, then the physician might intervene by making a correction to bring the body back into balance. For example, if the individual were too full of phlegm (making her phlegmatic or lethargic), then the phlegm must be countered. Citrus fruit was thought to be a counter-acting agent. Thus, if one feels lethargic, increasing one’s citrus intake will re-create balance. The treatment is, in fact, generally effective. Moderns might describe the therapy differently by ascribing the effect to vitamin-C, phosphorus, and natural sugar. This example illustrates the scope of the Hippocratic physician in this context: something like a cross between the modern roles of an herbalist dietician and a personal trainer. Nonetheless, the cures that were dictated by the four humor theory seemed to work well enough for this theory to extend to the nineteenth century (in various guises).

b. An Ancient Debate: Are General Causal Theories Beneficial?

Other biomedical writers–some say from Cnidos–held that strict empirical principles did not allow scientists to go far beyond the data. It was a better methodology for the biomedical practitioner to stay as close as possible to the data that were before him. This meant that each patient would be seen in her particularity. Such a method required careful trial and error observation and only slight manipulation of the patient in the form of treatment.

There was a great conflict in the ancient world concerning the status of observational conclusions (the empirically concrete). Should they be given in their specificity and remain as disparate, individual accounts, or should they be grouped and more general principles drawn from them? In this instance it was very much in dispute whether it was better to set out individual reports of particular illnesses (case studies) or to try to draw general rules from the particulars.

Take, for example Epidemics III:

THE MORTIFICATION OF THE GANGRENE. If the gangrene mortifies itself there is a head pain and frequently a scratchy throat; the sick limb loses sensation, a feeling of cold comes to the head and the affected limb sweats. He suddenly loses his speech and blows blood from his nose as he becomes pale. If the disease takes hold of the patient with a weak force, he recovers the discharged blood. If the disease takes him with a strong force, he dies promptly. In this case one induces sneezing by pleasant substances; one evacuates by the upper and lower. Alternatively those odors will be a little active. The soup will be light and hot. Wine is absolutely forbidden. (Epidemics III, Littré 7, p. 123)

In this passage one is left merely with symptoms and treatment. But when one practices medicine in this way there are severe restrictions. For the disease is seen as a collection of symptoms. The cure can only be guessed at unless it has been previously written down in a manual. When a physician is confronted with a novel disease he must find a similar set of symptoms and use that treatment. This aspect of the “trial and error” method brought harsh rebuke from Galen.

The point is that they [the Cnidians] looked at the varieties of symptoms which change for many reasons and failed to consider the specificity of the dispositions, as did Hippocrates, who used for their discovery a method only by using which, one can find the number of diseases . . . . Hippocrates censures the Cnidian physicians for their ignorance of the genera and species of diseases, and he points out the divisions by which what seems to be one becomes many by being divided. (Corpus Medicorum Graecorum 5.9.1, pp. 121-22; Claudii Galeni De Placitis Hippocratis et Platonis, ed. I. Mueller (Lipsiae, 1874), p. 776)

c. Prognosis and Treatment

What was it that made the Cnidians different from the Coan writers? This can be found by examining the two steps in any medical practice: Prognosis and Treatment. In the Coan work, On Prognosis, the writer suggests that prognosis consists in knowing the patient’s condition in the past, present, and the future. Now how could a physician know this? Well, this could also have been part of a handbook catalogued through similar case studies. The practitioner could memorize each individual description. Next, the practitioner could add to this his own experience. But the problem is that each case is individual. It possesses “nature” only in the sense of possessing a unique set of properties. The practitioner would not be in a good position to treat novel cases. When confronted with a novel case, the practitioner is left with seeking similar cases. The implied premise is that similar cases call for similar remedies. The more the experience, the more refined the practitioner can be in balancing similar cases with the remedies.

Obviously, much rides on the word, ‘similar.’ Is a rich body of knowledge enough? Is it not also requisite to have a classification procedure, which itself implies rules of classification. And how does one select and justify such rules? It would seem that we are pressed backwards toward archai, starting points for some axiomatic system (à la Aristotle’s Posterior Analytics, I, i-ii).

Such an alternative to the empiricist program aims at establishing a theory of causes that underlie individual cases. These causes such as the “hot,” “cold,” “wet,” and “dry” or “the four humors” are more general because they seek to describe a different sense of the nature of disease. ‘Nature’ in this context refers to the sort of condition that comes from observations based upon the individuality of actual patients. For here we are interested in the genera and species of the disease in question. Such an exercise creates a classification of types of diseases.

But for this classification not to be based upon accidental characteristics, it is requisite that it include the causal factors that operate to bring about the disease in the first place. This is really the foundational or causal network that is responsible for the disease’s very existence. Such an understanding of “nature” moves away from individuals and their “similarities” toward the theoretical. Understood in this way, the nature of disease is a regulating factor upon the prognosis of the physician. This nature must be understood in order to offer treatment. In this sense, nature is the overarching principles that give an account of the mechanism of the disease. What made the Coan writers so attractive to Galen was that they investigated various senses of nature while the Cnidians confined themselves only to the data as they presented themselves.

d. The Hippocratic Writings and Hellenistic Medicine

The Hippocratic writings were influential in the development of later biomedical practitioners. The three principal Hellenistic schools: Dogmatists, Methodists, and the Empirics all hearken back in various ways to the Hippocratic writings. Many debates in the Hippocratic writings (such as the “preformation” vs. “epigenesis” debate) are picked-up again and given a twist according to the predilections of the Hellenistic schools. Galen, himself, often cites Hippocrates, aka “the Hippocratic writers,” as the point of departure for his own theory building. Thus, it would be fair to say that not only were the Hippocratic writers the first systematic biomedical writers in the Western tradition, but also the most influential to later writers.

2. Ethics

In the time of Hippocrates (and the other associated writers) there were many who wanted to pass themselves off as physicians. These individuals had not gone through an apprenticeship and thus had no specialized (professional) knowledge. Because of this, these con men went about fleecing customers. This created a problem for those who entered the study of medicine the traditional way. These more careful practitioners had to distinguish themselves from the charlatans. The way most professions try to deal with this sort of problem and the legitimate problems that arise during practice is to create codes of conduct and structures of accreditation. The most famous of these in the biomedical tradition is: The Oath of Hippocrates.

a. The Oath

By Apollo (the physician), by Asclepius (god of healing), by Hygeia (god of health), by Panacea (god of remedy), and all the gods and goddesses, together as witnesses, I hereby swear that I will carry out, inasmuch as I am able and true to my considered judgment, this oath and the ensuing duties:

1. To hold my teacher in this art on a par with my parents. To make my teacher a partner in my livelihood To look after my teacher and financially share with her/him when s/he is in need. To consider him/her as a brother/sister along with his/her family. To teach his/her family the art of medicine, if they want to learn it, without tuition or any other conditions of service. To impart all the lessons necessary to practice medicine to my own sons and daughters, the sons and daughters of my teacher and to my own students, who have taken this oath-but to no one else.
2. I will help the sick according to my skill and judgment, but never with an intent to do harm or injury to another.
3. I will never administer poison to anyone-even when asked to do so. Nor will I ever suggest a way that others (even the patient) could do so. Similarly, I will never induce an abortion. Instead, I will keep holy my life and art.
4. I will not engage in surgery–not even upon suffers from stone, but will withdraw in favor of others who do this work.
5. Whoever I visit, rich or poor, I will concern myself with the well being of the sick. I will commit no intentional misdeeds, nor any other harmful action such as engaging in sexual relations with my patients (regardless of their status).
6. Whatever I hear or see in the course of my professional duties (or even outside the course of treatment) regarding my patients is strictly confidential and I will not allow it to be spread about. But instead, will hold these as holy secrets.

Now if I carry out this oath and not break its injunctions, may I enjoy a good life and may my reputation be pure and honored for all generations. But if I fail and break this oath, then may the opposite befall me.

Within this oath are both a moral code for the profession of medicine and the outlines of a system of accreditation for new physicians via an apprenticeship. These two functions went a long way to establishing medicine as a profession that ordinary people could trust.

b. The Oath and Modern Codes of Conduct

In the modern world there are many professional codes of conduct. One could look at the American Medical Association Code, the American Bar Association Code, et al. However, the Hippocratic Oath set the standard of what a professional code is. A few key features that will tell why one should accept or reject such codes as solutions to the problems that have been outlined.

It is this author’s opinion that among professional codes, the Hippocratic Oath is a good one. It balances between very specific prohibitions such as not administering poison or not having sexual relations with one’s patients, to more general principles such as “I will concern myself with the well being of the sick.” and “do no harm.” These general principles are very useful because they govern a larger domain than simply prohibiting a particular action. These principles are not set out without context. Instead they are put into the context medicine’s mission.

Beginning in #1 the tone is set that medicine is an art that is “given by the gods.” It is an esoteric art that is to be reserved for those who are willing to commit to the provisions of the code. Thus, it is not open to everyone. This fulfills the condition of specialized knowledge mentioned earlier. It is for the sake of doing good to others and always avoiding harm. This fulfills the condition of providing a service for others.

Thirdly, the code ties itself to the larger moral tradition, “I will commit no intentional misdeeds.” Whereas “harm” has a direct link to manner in which medicine is practiced, “misdeeds” links the physician to the larger moral tradition. There is no possible hiding in the shared community perspective alone.

These three factors are the basis of any good professional code.

A Good Professional Code Should Contain

1. A specific listing of common abuses.
2. A few general guidelines that tie behavior to the mission of the profession.
3. A link to general theories of morality.

Where codes of professional ethics fail is in overemphasizing one of these elements too highly or in ignoring an element entirely. If codes of ethics exist in order to remedy the “inward perspective” problem described above, then they must create links to more general “shared worldviews.” This would put them in the realm of common morality.

This is the most important point from my perspective. So often the “practice” of the profession defines its excellence in an introspective way such that the achievement of these functional requirements is all that matters-divorced from any other visions, namely, moral visions.

In the modern arena, many professional codes have evolved from a legal perspective. The practitioners of the profession do not want to go to jail or to be sued. Thus, they create certain codes that will make this possible situation less probable. These sorts of codes are defensive in nature and stand at the opposite end of the spectrum from the Hippocratic Oath. Their mission is not to set internal standards and link to common morality, rather they seek to “shave” as close as possible to maximizing an egoistic bottom line at the expense of the pillars of professionalism: one’s specialized education and one’s mission to serve others.

Any code that takes as its basis merely a negative approach designed to protect the practitioner from going to jail or being sued is fundamentally inadequate. This is not where one should set her sights. Rather, we should dream about what the profession may be-in the best of all possible worlds. The Oath of Hippocrates thus properly sets the mission that should drive all codes of ethics.

3. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

• Corpus Medicorum Graecorum (Berlin: Akademie-Verlag, on-going).
  • New editions of selected texts with excellent notes and apparatus by various editors.
• Hippocrate, Oeuvres. Paris: Les Belles Lettres, 1967-2008.
• Hippocrates, selected works Loeb series. 8 vols. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1923-1995.
• Littré, E. Oeuvres complète d’hippocrate 10 vols. (Paris: J. B. Billière, 1851).
  • The standard edition.

b. Secondary Sources

• Bourgey, Louis, Observation et experience chez les médecins de la collection hippocratique. (Paris: J. Vrin, 1953).
  • A fine connection to principles in the philosophy of science.
• Edelstein, Ludwig Ancient Medicine. (Baltimore, MD: Johns Hopkins University Press, 1967).
  • Still the best single treatment of ancient biomedical practitioners.
• Jouanna, Jacques. Hipporcrate Translated as Hippocrates by M. B. DeBevoise (Baltimore, MD: Johns Hopkins University Press, 1999).
  • A broad and speculative treatment.
• Jouanna, Jacques. Hippocrate: pour une archéologie d l’école de Cnide. (Paris: Belles Lettres, 1974).
  • A fine detailed analysis.
• Lloyd, G.E.R. Early Greek Science: Thales to Aristotle. (New York: Norton, 1970).
  • An overview for the student interested in an introduction.
• Lloyd, G.E.R. Magic, Reason, and Experience. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1979).
  • Perhaps Lloyd’s best analytical work by one of the finest practitioners of ancient scientific history.
• Smith, Wesley. The Hippocratic Tradition. (Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press, 1979). Second edition revised 2002 – available online at: http://www.bium.univ-paris5.fr/amn/Hippo2.pdf (accessed on August 26, 2009).
  • A solid overview by an excellent scholar.
• Temkin, Owsei. Hippocrates in a World of Pagans and Christians. (Baltimore, MD: Johns Hopkins University Press, 1991).
  • A wide-ranging work that stimulates in the tradition of the history of ideas.

c. Published Conferences on Hippocrates

#1 French

• La Collection Hippocratique et son role dans l’histoire medicine : Colloque de Strasbourg (23-27 Octobre 1972). (1975). Paper presented at the Colloque Sur La Collection Hippocratique Et Son Role Dans l’Histoire Medicale (1972 : Strasbourg); Universite Des Sciences Humaines De Strasbourg. Centre De Recherche Sur La Proche-Orient Et La Grece Antiques. Travaux, 2.

#2 French

• Joly, R., (1977). Corpus hippocraticum : Actes du Colloque Hippocratique de Mons (22-26 Septembre 1975). Paper presented at the Colloque Hippocratique, 2nd, Mons, 1975.; Éditions Universitaires De Mons. Série Sciences Humaines ; 4.

#3 French

• Grmek, M. D. (1980). Hippocratica : Actes du Colloque Hippocratique de Paris, 4-9 Septembre 1978. Paper presented at the Colloque Hippocratique De Paris (1978); Colloques Internationaux Du Centre National De La Recherche Scientifique ; no 583; Variation: Colloques Internationaux Du Centre National De La Recherche Scientifique ; no 583.

#4 French

• Lasserre, F., & Mudry, P. (1983). Formes de pensée dans la collection Hippocratique : Actes du IVe Colloque International Hippocratique : Lausanne, 21-26 Septembre 1981. Paper presented at the International Hippocrates Colloquium (4th : 1981 : Lausanne, Switzerland); Publications De La Faculté Des Lettres ; 26; Variation: Publications De La Faculté Des Lettres (Université De Lausanne. Faculté Des Lettres) ; 26.

#5 German

• Baader, G., Winau, R., Berliner Gesellschaft für Geschichte der Medizin, Freie Universität Berlin, & Institut für Geschichte der Medizin. (1989). Die Hippokratischen epidemien : Theorie-praxis-tradition : Verhandlungen des ve Colloque International Hippocratique. Paper presented at the International Hippocrates Colloquium (5th : 1984 : Berlin, Germany); Sudhoffs Archiv,; Beihefte ; Heft 27, 441.

#6 French

• Potter, P., Maloney, G., & Desautels, J. (1990). La maladie et les maladies dans la Collection Hippocratique : Actes du VIe Colloque International Hippocratique, Québec du 28 Septembre au 3 Octobre 1987. Paper presented at the Colloque International Hippocratique (6e : 1987 : Québec, Québec),

#7 Spanish

• López Férez, J. A. (1992). Tratados hipocráticos : Estudios acerca de su contenido, forma e influencia : Actas del VIIe Colloque International Hippocratique, Madrid, 24-29 de Septiembre de 1990. Paper presented at the Colloque International Hippocratique (7th : 1990 : Madrid, Spain),

#8 German

• Wittern, R., & Pellegrin, P. (1996). Hippokratische medizin und antike philosophie : Verhandlungen des VIII. Internationalen Hippokrates-Kolloquiums in Kloster Banz/Staffelstein vom 23.-28. Sept. 1993. Paper presented at the International Hippocrates Colloquium (8th : 1993 : Kloster Banz/Staffelstein); Medizin Der Antike; Bd. 1, 654.

#9 multiple languages

• Garofalo, I. (1999). Aspetti della terapia nel corpus hippocraticum : Atti del IXe Colloque International Hippocratique, Pisa, 25-29 Settembre 1996. Paper presented at the International Hippocrates Colloquium (9th : 1996 : Pisa, Italy); Studi / Accademia Toscana Di Scienze e Lettere La Colombaria; 183; Variation: Studi (Accademia Toscana Di Scienze e Lettere La Colombaria); 183. 716.

#10 French

• Thivel, A., & Zucker, A. (2002). Le normal et le pathologique dans la collection Hippocratique : Actes du xème Colloque International Hippocratique, Nice, 6-8 Octobre 1999. Paper presented at the Colloque International Hippocratique (10th : 1999 : Nice, France),

#11 English

• Van der Eijk, P. J. (2005). Hippocrates in context : Papers read at the XIth international Hippocrates colloquium, University of Newcastle upon Tyne, 27-31 August 2002. Paper presented at the International Hippocrates Colloquium (11th : 2002 : University of Newcastle upon Tyne); Studies in Ancient Medicine,; v. 31, 521. Retrieved from http://www.loc.gov/catdir/toc/fy0606/2006295344.html; Materials specified: Table of contents http://www.loc.gov/catdir/toc/fy0606/2006295344.html

Author Information

Michael Boylan
Email: michael.boylan@marymount.edu
Marymount University
U. S. A.

Hipparchia (fl. 300 B.C.E.)

Hipparchia is notable for being one of the few women philosophers of Ancient Greece.  Drawn to the doctrines and the self-imposed hardships of the Cynic lifestyle, Hipparchia lived in poverty with her husband, Crates the Cynic. While no existing writings are directly attributed to Hipparchia, recorded anecdotal accounts emphasize both her direct, Cynic rhetoric and her nonconformity to traditional gendered roles. Entering into marriage is a traditional social role that Cynics would normally reject; yet with her marriage to Crates, Hipparchia raised  Greek cultural expectations regarding the role of women in marriage, as well as the Cynic doctrine itself. With her husband, Hipparchia publicly embodied fundamental Cynic principles, specifically that the path toward virtue was the result of rational actors living in accordance with a natural law that eschewed conventional materialism and embraced both self-sufficiency and mental asperity.  Written accounts of Hipparchia’s life reference in particular both her belief in human shamelessness or anaideia, and her rhetorical acuity at Greek symposiums traditionally attended only by men.  Along with Crates, Hipparchia is considered a direct influence on the later school of Stoicism.

Table of Contents

1. Life and Philosophy
2. References and Further Reading

1. Life and Philosophy

Hipparchia was a Cynic philosopher from Maroneia in Thrace, who flourished around 300 B.C.E. She became famous for her marriage to Crates the Cynic, and infamous for supposedly consummating the marriage in public. Hipparchia was likely born between 340 and 330 B.C.E., and was probably in her mid-teens when she decided to adopt the Cynic mantle. She may have been introduced to philosophy by her brother, Metrocles, who was a pupil in Aristotle’s Lyceum and later began to follow Crates. Most of our knowledge about Hipparchia comes from anecdotes and sayings repeated by later authors. Diogenes Laertius reports that she wrote some letters, jokes and philosophical refutations, which are now lost (see Diogenes Laertius, Lives of Eminent Philosophers, Vol. II, tr. R. D. Hicks, Cambridge: Harvard University Press, 1925, reprint 1995, VI.96-98). He adds that myriad stories were told about “the female philosopher”.

Diogenes Laertius claims that Hipparchia was so eager to marry Crates that she threatened to kill herself rather than live in any other way. (DL VI.96.7-8) Although Crates was by this time an old man, she rejected her other youthful suitors because she had fallen in love with “both the discourses and the life” of Crates, and was said to be “captured” by the logos of the Cynics. (VI.96.1 and 4-5) At the request of her parents, Crates tried to talk Hipparchia out of the marriage. (VI.96.9-10) When he failed in this task, he disrobed in front of her and said, “this is the groom, and these are his possessions; choose accordingly.” (VI.96.11-15) This tale should be taken with the proverbial grain of salt, given that Diogenes Laertius is writing centuries later, and that his account may include ‘apt’ stories that are technically false, but which arose and were transmitted because they were taken to be revealing illustrations. Given the interest and controversy generated by the female Cynic, it is easy to imagine stories of this kind being told about her. In any event, we know that Hipparchia chose to marry Crates and share his philosophical pursuits.

Hipparchia’s decision to become a Cynic was surprising, on account of both the Cynic disregard for conventional institutions and the extreme hardship of the lifestyle. Cynics attempted to live “according to nature” by rejecting artificial social conventions and refusing all luxuries, including any items not absolutely required for survival. They gave up their possessions, carrying what few they needed in a wallet. They wore only a simple mantle or cloak, and begged to obtain their basic needs. Crates’ willingness to marry was also unusual, considering that marriage is a social institution of the sort normally rejected by Cynics, and earlier Cynics like Diogenes and Antisthenes had maintained that the philosopher would never marry. A few centuries later, while arguing that marriage is generally unsuitable for the Cynic (or Stoic) philosopher, Epictetus allows for exceptions specifically because of the philosophical marriage of Hipparchia and Crates (Epictetus, Discourses, tr. C. H. Oldfather, Cambridge: Harvard University Press, 1928). By marrying a Cynic and becoming one herself, Hipparchia thus performed the characteristically Cynic feat of “changing the currency,” both of her culture and the Cynic tradition itself. The Cynic motto of “change the currency” (parakrattein to nomismata), first adopted by Diogenes of Sinope, implied rejection of the prevailing social and political order in favor of an unconventional, self-sufficient life as a “citizen of the universe” (kosmopolites). (It had been said, perhaps falsely, that Diogenes or his father had been driven from Sinope when found guilty of literally defacing the coins and changing their values, but it is also likely that the counterfeiting story arose after he adopted the metaphorical motto.)

Some later authors, such as Apuleius and Augustine, report that Hipparchia and Crates consummated their marriage by having sex on a public porch. Whether the tale is accurate or not, they were known to conduct themselves in all respects according to the Cynic value of anaideia, or shamelessness. The story of Hipparchia’s Cynic marriage quickly became the premiere example of that virtue, which is based on the Cynic belief that any actions virtuous enough to be done in private are no less virtuous when performed in public. As exemplars of anaideia, Hipparchia and Crates influenced their pupil Zeno of Citium, the founder of Stoicism. His Republic advocates the equality of the sexes, co-ed public exercise and training, and a version of “free love” wherein those wishing to have sex will simply satisfy their desires wherever they happen to be at the moment, even in public. Stoic ethics were generally influenced by Cynic values, such as self-sufficiency, the importance of practice in achieving virtue, and the rejection of the conventional values attached to pleasure and pain. The Stoics also advocated living according to nature in the sense of conforming one’s own reason to the dictates of the rational natural law.

Eratosthenes reports that Hipparchia and Crates had a son named Pasicles, and Diogenes Laertius’ account of the life of Crates also refers to their son. The Cynic Letters, a collection of pseudographic letters attributed to various Cynic figures and probably written by a several different authors a few centuries after Hipparchia lived, mention that she bore and raised children according to her Cynic values. Whatever the actual details of her practices might have been, her example influenced later Cynic attitudes towards pregnancy and child-rearing. For example, one of the letters attributed to Crates suggests that Hipparchia has given birth “without trouble” because she believes that her usual “labor is the cause of not laboring” during the birth itself (33.14-15). The birth was easier because she continued to work “like an athlete” during her pregnancy (33.17), which the author notes is unusual. The letters also mention Hipparchia’s use of a tortoise shell cradle, cold water for the baby’s bath, and continued adherence to an austere diet.

Hipparchia is also famous for an exchange with Theodorus the Atheist, a Cyrenaic philosopher, who had challenged the legitimacy of her presence at a symposium. She was reported to have regularly attended such functions with Crates. According to Diogenes Laertius, Theodorus quoted a verse from Euripides’ Bacchae, asking if this is she “abandoning the warp and woof and the shuttle” (like Agave returning home from the “hunt” with the head of her son Pentheus). (VI.98.2) Hipparchia affirms that yes, it is she, but asks Theodorus whether she has had the wrong understanding of herself, if she spent her time on education rather than wasting it on the loom. (VI.98.3-6) In the ancient Greek cultural context, women of her social class typically would have been occupied with weaving and organizing the household servants, and Hipparchia’s rejection of the conventional expectations for women was quite radical.

Diogenes Laertius also reports the syllogism that Hipparchia used to put down Theodorus during the same symposium mentioned above: Premise 1: “Any action which would not be called wrong if done by Theodorus, would not be called wrong if done by Hipparchia.” Premise 2: “Now Theodorus does no wrong when he strikes himself”. Conclusion: “therefore neither does Hipparchia do wrong when she strikes Theodorus.” (VI.97.6-9) This is a classic example of the Cynic rhetorical trope of spoudogeloion: a deliberately comic syllogism which nevertheless makes a serious point. Diogenes Laertius says that since Theodorus “had no reply wherefore to meet the argument,” he “tried to strip her of her cloak. But Hipparchia showed no sign of alarm or of the perturbation natural in a woman” (VI.97), as befitted her Cynic commitment to anaideia.

2. References and Further Reading

Diogenes Laertius, Lives of Eminent Philosophers, Vol. II, tr. R. D. Hicks (Cambridge: Harvard University Press) 1925 (reprint 1995), VI.96-98.

Abraham J. Malherbe, The Cynic Epistles (Atlanta: Scholar’s Press) 1997, 78-83.

Discussions in the modern period of Hipparchia’s encounter with Theodorus are found in Bayle’s Historical and Critical Dictionary and in Menage’s History of Women Philosophers. See Pierre Bayle, Historical and Critical Dictionary: Selections, ed. Richard H. Popkin and Craig Bush (Indianapolis: Hackett) 1991, 102-103, and Gilles Menage, The History of Women Philosophers, tr. Beatrice H. Zedler (Lanham, MD: University Press of America, 1984), 103.

For further information about Cynic philosophy, see Diogenes Laertius Book VI, as well as D. R. Dudley, A History of Cynicism: From Diogenes to the Sixth Century AD (London) 1937 (reprint Ares Publishing, 1980), and R. Bracht Branham and Marie Odile Goulet-Caze, eds., The Cynics: The Cynic Movement in Antiquity and its Legacy (Berkeley: University of California Press) 2000.

Author Information

Laura Grams
Email: lgrams@mail.unomaha.edu
University of Nebraska at Omaha
U. S. A.

Heraclitus (fl. c. 500 B.C.E.)

A Greek philosopher of the late 6th century BCE, Heraclitus criticizes his predecessors and contemporaries for their failure to see the unity in experience. He claims to announce an everlasting Word (Logos) according to which all things are one, in some sense. Opposites are necessary for life, but they are unified in a system of balanced exchanges. The world itself consists of a law-like interchange of elements, symbolized by fire. Thus the world is not to be identified with any particular substance, but rather with an ongoing process governed by a law of change. The underlying law of nature also manifests itself as a moral law for human beings. Heraclitus is the first Western philosopher to go beyond physical theory in search of metaphysical foundations and moral applications.

Table of Contents

1. Life and Times
2. Theory of Knowledge
3. The Doctrine of Flux and the Unity of Opposites
4. Criticism of Ionian Philosophy
5. Physical Theory
6. Moral and Political Theory
7. Accomplishments and Influence
8. References and Further Reading

1. Life and Times

Heraclitus lived in Ephesus, an important city on the Ionian coast of Asia Minor, not far from Miletus, the birthplace of philosophy. We know nothing about his life other than what can be gleaned from his own statements, for all ancient biographies of him consist of nothing more than inferences or imaginary constructions based on his sayings. Although Plato thought he wrote after Parmenides, it is more likely he wrote before Parmenides. For he criticizes by name important thinkers and writers with whom he disagrees, and he does not mention Parmenides. On the other hand, Parmenides in his poem arguably echoes the words of Heraclitus.  Heraclitus criticizes the mythographers Homer and Hesiod, as well as the philosophers Pythagoras and Xenophanes and the historian Hecataeus. All of these figures flourished in the 6th century BCE or earlier, suggesting a date for Heraclitus in the late 6th century. Although he does not speak in detail of his political views in the extant fragments, Heraclitus seems to reflect an aristocratic disdain for the masses and favor the rule of a few wise men, for instance when he recommends that his fellow-citizens hang themselves because they have banished their most prominent leader (DK22B121 in the Diels-Kranz collection of Presocratic sources).

2. Theory of Knowledge

Heraclitus sees the great majority of human beings as lacking understanding:

Of this Word’s being forever do men prove to be uncomprehending, both before they hear and once they have heard it. For although all things happen according to this Word they are like the unexperienced experiencing words and deeds such as I explain when I distinguish each thing according to its nature and declare how it is. Other men are unaware of what they do when they are awake just as they are forgetful of what they do when they are asleep. (DK22B1)

Most people sleep-walk through life, not understanding what is going on about them. Yet experience of words and deeds can enlighten those who are receptive to their meaning. (The opening sentence is ambiguous: does the ‘forever’ go with the preceding or the following words? Heraclitus prefigures the semantic complexity of his message.)

On the one hand, Heraclitus commends sense experience: “The things of which there is sight, hearing, experience, I prefer” (DK22B55). On the other hand, “Poor witnesses for men are their eyes and ears if they have barbarian souls” (DK22B107). A barbarian is one who does not speak the Greek language. Thus while sense experience seems necessary for understanding, if we do not know the right language, we cannot interpret the information the senses provide. Heraclitus does not give a detailed and systematic account of the respective roles of experience and reason in knowledge. But we can learn something from his manner of expression.

Describing the practice of religious prophets, Heraclitus says, “The Lord whose oracle is at Delphi neither reveals nor conceals, but gives a sign” (DK22B93). Similarly, Heraclitus does not reveal or conceal, but produces complex expressions that have encoded in them multiple messages for those who can interpret them. He uses puns, paradoxes, antitheses, parallels, and various rhetorical and literary devices to construct expressions that have meanings beyond the obvious. This practice, together with his emphasis on the Word (Logos) as an ordering principle of the world, suggests that he sees his own expressions as imitations of the world with its structural and semantic complexity. To read Heraclitus the reader must solve verbal puzzles, and to learn to solve these puzzles is to learn to read the signs of the world. Heraclitus stresses the inductive rather than the deductive method of grasping the world, a world that is rationally structured, if we can but discern its shape.

For those who can discern it, the Word has an overriding message to impart: “Listening not to me but to the Word it is wise to agree that all things are one” (DK22B50). It is perhaps Heraclitus’s chief project to explain in what sense all things are one.

3. The Doctrine of Flux and the Unity of Opposites

According to both Plato and Aristotle, Heraclitus held extreme views that led to logical incoherence. For he held that (1) everything is constantly changing and (2) opposite things are identical, so that (3) everything is and is not at the same time. In other words, Universal Flux and the Identity of Opposites entail a denial of the Law of Non-Contradiction. Plato indicates the source of the flux doctrine: “Heraclitus, I believe, says that all things go and nothing stays, and comparing existents to the flow of a river, he says you could not step twice into the same river” (Cratylus 402a = DK22A6).

What Heraclitus actually says is the following:

On those stepping into rivers staying the same other and other waters flow. (DK22B12)

There is an antithesis between ‘same’ and ‘other.’ The sentence says that different waters flow in rivers staying the same. In other words, though the waters are always changing, the rivers stay the same. Indeed, it must be precisely because the waters are always changing that there are rivers at all, rather than lakes or ponds. The message is that rivers can stay the same over time even though, or indeed because, the waters change. The point, then, is not that everything is changing, but that the fact that some things change makes possible the continued existence of other things. Perhaps more generally, the change in elements or constituents supports the constancy of higher-level structures.As for the alleged doctrine of the Identity of Opposites, Heraclitus does believe in some kind of unity of opposites. For instance, “God is day night, winter summer, war peace, satiety hunger . . .” (DK22B67). But if we look closer, we see that the unity in question is not identity:

As the same thing in us is living and dead, waking and sleeping, young and old. For these things having changed around are those, and conversely those having changed around are these. (DK22B88)

The second sentence in B88 gives the explanation for the first. If F is the same as G because F turns into G, then the two are not identical. And Heraclitus insists on the common-sense truth of change: “Cold things warm up, the hot cools off, wet becomes dry, dry becomes wet” (DK22B126). This sort of mutual change presupposes the non-identity of the terms. What Heraclitus wishes to maintain is not the identity of opposites but the fact that they replace each other in a series of transformations: they are interchangeable or transformationally equivalent.

Thus, Heraclitus does not hold Universal Flux, but recognizes a lawlike flux of elements; and he does not hold the Identity of Opposites, but the Transformational Equivalence of Opposites. The views that he does hold do not, jointly or separately, entail a denial of the Law of Non-Contradiction. Heraclitus does, to be sure, make paradoxical statements, but his views are no more self-contradictory than are the paradoxical claims of Socrates. They are, presumably, meant to wake us up from our dogmatic slumbers.

4. Criticism of Ionian Philosophy

Heraclitus’ theory can be understood as a response to the philosophy of his Ionian predecessors. The philosophers of the city of Miletus (near Ephesus), Thales, Anaximander, and Anaximenes, believed some original material turns into all other things. The world as we know it is the orderly articulation of different stuffs produced out of the original stuff. For the Milesians, to explain the world and its phenomena was just to show how everything came from the original stuff, such as Thales’ water or Anaximenes’ air.

Heraclitus seems to follow this pattern of explanation when he refers to the world as “everliving fire” (DK22B30, quoted in full in next section) and makes statements such as “Thunderbolt steers all things,” alluding to the directive power of fire (DK22B64). But fire is a strange stuff to make the origin of all things, for it is the most inconstant and changeable. It is, indeed, a symbol of change and process. Heraclitus observes,

All things are an exchange for fire, and fire for all things, as goods for gold and gold for goods. (DK22B90)

We can measure all things against fire as a standard; there is an equivalence between all things and gold, but all things are not identical to gold. Similarly, fire provides a standard of value for other stuffs, but it is not identical to them. Fire plays an important role in Heraclitus’ system, but it is not the unique source of all things, because all stuffs are equivalent.

Ultimately, fire may be more important as a symbol than as a stuff. Fire is constantly changing-but so is every other stuff. One thing is transformed into another in a cycle of changes. What is constant is not some stuff, but the overall process of change itself. There is a constant law of transformations, which is, perhaps, to be identified with the Logos. Heraclitus may be saying that the Milesians correctly saw that one stuff turns into another in a series, but they incorrectly inferred from this that some one stuff is the source of everything else. But if A is the source of B and B of C, and C turns back into B and then A, then B is likewise the source of A and C, and C is the source of A and B. There is no particular reason to promote one stuff at the expense of the others. What is important about the stuffs is that they change into others. The one constant in the whole process is the law of change by which there is an order and sequence to the changes. If this is what Heraclitus has in mind, he goes beyond the physical theory of his early predecessors to arrive at something like a process philosophy with a sophisticated understanding of metaphysics.

5. Physical Theory

Heraclitus’ criticisms and metaphysical speculations are grounded in a physical theory. He expresses the principles of his cosmology in a single sentence:

This world-order, the same of all, no god nor man did create, but it ever was and is and will be: everliving fire, kindling in measures and being quenched in measures. (DK22B30)

This passage contains the earliest extant philosophical use of the word kosmos, “world-order,” denoting the organized world in which we live, with earth, sea, atmosphere, and heavens. While ancient sources understand Heraclitus as saying the world comes to be and then perishes in a fiery holocaust, only to be born again (DK22A10), the present passage seems to contradict this reading: the world itself does not have a beginning or end. Parts of it are being consumed by fire at any given time, but the whole remains. Almost all other early cosmologists before and after Heraclitus explained the existence of the ordered world by recounting its origin out of elemental stuffs. Some also predicted the extinction of the world. But Heraclitus, the philosopher of flux, believes that as the stuffs turn into one another, the world itself remains stable. How can that be?

Heraclitus explains the order and proportion in which the stuffs change:

The turnings of fire: first sea, and of sea, half is earth, half firewind (prêstêr: some sort of fiery meteorological phenomenon). (DK22B31a)

Sea is liquefied and measured into the same proportion as it had before it became earth. (DK22B31b)

Fire is transformed into water (“sea”) of which half turns back into fire (“firewind”) and half into earth. Thus there is a sequence of stuffs: fire, water, earth, which are interconnected. When earth turns back into sea, it occupies the same volume as it had before it turned into earth. Thus we can recognize a primitive law of conservation-not precisely conservation of matter, at least the identity of the matter is not conserved, nor of mass, but at least an equivalence of matter is maintained. Although the fragments do not give detailed information about Heraclitus’ physics, it seems likely that the amount of water that evaporates each day is balanced by the amount of stuff that precipitates as water, and so on, so that a balance of stuffs is maintained even though portions of stuff are constantly changing their identity.

For Heraclitus, flux and opposition are necessary for life. Aristotle reports,

Heraclitus criticizes the poet who said, ‘would that strife might perish from among gods and men’ [Homer Iliad 18.107]’ for there would not be harmony without high and low notes, nor living things without female and male, which are opposites. (DK22A22)

Heraclitus views strife or conflict as maintaining the world:

We must recognize that war is common and strife is justice, and all things happen according to strife and necessity. (DK22B80)

War is the father of all and king of all, who manifested some as gods and some as men, who made some slaves and some freemen. (DK22B53)

In a tacit criticism of Anaximander, Heraclitus rejects the view that cosmic justice is designed to punish one opposite for its transgressions against another. If it were not for the constant conflict of opposites, there would be no alternations of day and night, hot and cold, summer and winter, even life and death. Indeed, if some things did not die, others would not be born. Conflict does not interfere with life, but rather is a precondition of life.

As we have seen, for Heraclitus fire changes into water and then into earth; earth changes into water and then into fire. At the level of either cosmic bodies (in which sea turns into fiery storms on the one hand and earth on the other) or domestic activities (in which, for instance, water boils out of a pot), there is constant flux among opposites. To maintain the balance of the world, we must posit an equal and opposite reaction to every change. Heraclitus observes,

The road up and down is one and the same. (DK22B60)

Here again we find a unity of opposites, but no contradiction. One road is used to pursue two different routes. Daily traffic carries some travelers out of the city, while it brings some back in. The image applies equally to physical theory: as earth changes to fire, fire changes to earth. And it may apply to psychology and other domains as well.

6. Moral and Political Theory

There has been some debate as to whether Heraclitus is chiefly a philosopher of nature (a view championed by G. S. Kirk) or a philosopher concerned with the human condition (C. H. Kahn). The opening words of Heraclitus’ book (DK22B1, quoted above) seem to indicate that he will expound the nature of things in a way that will have profound implications for human life. In other words, he seems to see the theory of nature and the human condition as intimately connected. In fact, recently discovered papyri have shown that Heraclitus is concerned with technical questions of astronomy, not only with general theory. There is no reason, then, to think of him as solely a humanist or moral philosopher. On the other hand, it would be wrong to think of him as a straightforward natural philosopher in the manner of other Ionian philosophers, for he is deeply concerned with the moral implications of physical theory.

Heraclitus views the soul as fiery in nature:

To souls it is death to become water, to water death to become earth, but from earth water is born, and from water soul. (DK22B36)

Soul is generated out of other substances just as fire is. But it has a limitless dimension:

If you went in search of it, you would not find the boundaries of the soul, though you traveled every road-so deep is its measure [logos]. (DK22B45)

Drunkenness damages the soul by causing it to be moist, while a virtuous life keeps the soul dry and intelligent. Souls seem to be able to survive death and to fare according to their character.

The laws of a city-state are an important principle of order:

The people [of a city] should fight for their laws as they would for their city wall. (DK22B44)

Speaking with sense we must rely on a common sense of all things, as a city relies on its wall, and much more reliably. For all human laws are nourished by the one divine law. For it prevails as far as it will and suffices for all and overflows. (DK22B114)

The laws provide a defense for a city and its way of life. But the laws are not merely of local interest: they derive their force from a divine law. Here we see the notion of a law of nature that informs human society as well as nature. There is a human cosmos that like the natural cosmos reflects an underlying order. The laws by which human societies are governed are not mere conventions, but are grounded in the ultimate nature of things. One cannot break a human law with impunity. The notion of a law-like order in nature has antecedents in the theory of Anaximander, and the notion of an inherent moral law influences the Stoics in the 3rd century BCE.

Heraclitus recognizes a divine unity behind the cosmos, one that is difficult to identify and perhaps impossible to separate from the processes of the cosmos:

The wise, being one thing only, would and would not take the name of Zeus [or: Life]. (DK22B32)

God is day night, winter summer, war peace, satiety hunger, and it alters just as when it is mixed with incense is named according to the aroma of each. (DK22B67)

Evidently the world either is god, or is a manifestation of the activity of god, which is somehow to be identified with the underlying order of things. God can be thought of as fire, but fire, as we have seen, is constantly changing, symbolic of transformation and process. Divinity is present in the world, but not as a conventional anthropomorphic being such as the Greeks worshiped.

7. Accomplishments and Influence

Heraclitus goes beyond the natural philosophy of the other Ionian philosophers to make profound criticisms and develop far-reaching implications of those criticisms. He suggests the first metaphysical foundation for philosophical speculation, anticipating process philosophy. And he makes human values a central concern of philosophy for the first time. His aphoristic manner of expression and his manner of propounding general truths through concrete examples remained unique.

Heraclitus’s paradoxical exposition may have spurred Parmenides’ rejection of Ionian philosophy. Empedocles and some medical writers echoed Heraclitean themes of alteration and ongoing process, while Democritus imitated his ethical observations. Influenced by the teachings of the Heraclitean Cratylus, Plato saw the sensible world as exemplifying a Heraclitean flux. Plato and Aristotle both criticized Heraclitus for a radical theory that led to a denial of the Law of Non-Contradiction. The Stoics adopted Heraclitus’s physical principles as the basis for their theories.

8. References and Further Reading

• Barnes, Jonathan. The Presocratic Philosophers. London: Routledge & Kegan Paul, 1982, vol. 1, ch. 4.
  • Uses modern arguments to defend the traditional view, going back to Plato and Aristotle, that Heraclitus’ commitment to the flux doctrine and the identity of opposites results in an incoherent theory.
• Graham, Daniel W. “Heraclitus’ Criticism of Ionian Philosophy.” Oxford Studies in Ancient Philosophy 15 (1997): 1-50.
  • Defends Heraclitus against the traditional view held by Barnes and others, and argues that his theory can be understood as a coherent criticism of earlier Ionian philosophy.
• Hussey, Edward. “Epistemology and Meaning in Heraclitus.” Language and Logos. Ed. M. Schofield and M. C. Nussbaum. Cambridge: Cambridge UP, 1982. 33-59.
  • Studies Heraclitus’ theory of knowledge.
• Kahn, Charles H. The Art and Thought of Heraclitus. Cambridge: Cambridge UP, 1979.
  • An important reassessment of Heraclitus that recognizes the literary complexity of his language as a key to interpreting his message. Focuses on Heraclitus as a philosopher of the human condition.
• Kirk, G. S. Heraclitus: The Cosmic Fragments. Cambridge: Cambridge UP, 1954.
  • Focuses on Heraclitus as a natural philosopher.
• Marcovich, Miroslav. Heraclitus: Greek Text with a Short Commentary. Merida, Venezuela: U. of the Andes, 1967.
  • A very thorough edition of Heraclitus, which effectively sorts out fragments from reports and reactions.
• Mourelatos, Alexander P. D. “Heraclitus, Parmenides, and the Naive Metaphysics of Things.” Exegesis and Argument. Ed. E. N. Lee et al. Assen: Van Gorcum, 1973. 16-48.
  • Examines Heraclitus’ response to the pre-philosophical understanding of things.
• Nussbaum, Martha C. “Psychê in Heraclitus.” Phronesis 17 (1972): 1-16, 153-70.
  • Good treatment of Heraclitus’ conception of soul.
• Robinson, T. M. Heraclitus: Fragments. Toronto: U of Toronto P, 1987.
  • Good brief edition with commentary.
• Vlastos, Gregory. “On Heraclitus.” American Journal of Philology 76 (1955): 337-68. Reprinted in G. Vlastos, Studies in Greek Philosophy, vol. 1, Princeton: Princeton U. Pr., 1995.
  • Vigorous defense of the traditional interpretation of Heraclitus against Kirk and others.

Author Information

Daniel W. Graham
Email: daniel_graham@byu.edu
Brigham Young University
U. S. A.