Plato: The Timaeus

There is nothing easy about the Timaeus. Its length, limited dramatic discourse, and arid subject-matter make for a dense and menacing work. But make no mistake, it is a menacing work of great subtly and depth. Cosmology has traditionally received the bulk of scholarly attention. No less important, however, are the dialogue’s narrative elements, beginning with its characters. Socrates needs no introduction, yet who are Timaeus, Critias, and Hermocrates, and why does Plato give them starring roles? Also worth considering is the dialogue’s narrative structure. What begins as a snappy exchange between Socrates and Timaeus soon gives way to a pair of protracted speeches. It is not like Socrates to sit idly by while others pontificate, yet he does. Is this a sign that Socrates endorses these speeches or is there another reason for his silence? And where is Plato? He is absent from the drama, but to what extent is he philosophically present? When reading a dramatic work, one ordinarily assumes a critical distance between the author and his characters. Is the Timaeus any different? Does Plato endorse any of the ideas presented? If he does, is there any way of telling which ideas given that he never speaks for himself?

Like any Platonic dialogue, the Timaeus is dynamic and multifarious—a complex interplay between muthos and logos, art and argument, theatrics and theory. The purpose of this entry is not to render a definitive interpretation of the dialogue, but rather to reveal the possibilities afforded by a close reading of the text.

Table of Contents

1. Authorship
2. Date of Composition
3. Dramatis Personæ
   1. Timaeus
   2. Socrates
   3. Critias
   4. Hermocrates
4. Dramatic Date and Setting
5. Narrative Structure
6. Outline & Analysis of the Dialogue
   1. Prologue, Part 1: An Invitation to Storytelling (17a–20c)
   2. Prologue, Part 2: The Story of Atlantis (20c–27b)
   3. Monologue, Part 1: The Creation Story of Intellect (27c–47e)
   4. Monologue, Part 2: The Creation Story of Necessity (47e–69a)
   5. Monologue, Part 3: The Creation Story of Man (69a–92c)
7. Concluding Remarks
8. References and Further Reading
   1. Standard Greek Text
   2. English Translations
   3. Classic Studies
   4. Classical Studies
   5. Other Studies of Related Interest

1. Authorship

Most scholars agree that Plato wrote somewhere between 30 and 40 dialogues. The precise number, however, is an open question owing to disputes over authorship. A case in point is First Alcibiades. Some scholars (such as Denyer) believe that it is authentic; others (such as Schleiermacher) do not. More commonly included among the Platonic dubia are the Cleitophon, Epinomis, Eryxias, Lovers, Minos, Second Alcibiades, and Theages (but reference Altman’s “Reading Order and Authenticity: The Place of Theages and Cleitophon in Platonic Pedagogy”). While doubts surround the authorship of some dialogues, this is not so with the Timaeus, and for good reason. As evidence, we have, for starters, ancient testimony. We find, for instance, in Aristotle more references to the Timaeus than to any other dialogue. It seems unlikely that Aristotle—given his familiarity with Plato’s works, having spent nearly 20 years in the Academy—would have repeatedly attributed this work to Plato if its authorship were doubtful. The Timaeus retained its place in the Platonic corpus throughout late antiquity and the Middle Ages. It was translated into Latin by Cicero (whose translation ends at 47b) and Calcidius, and it inspired commentaries by Plutarch and Proclus. At no point in its transmission was its authorship seriously contested. Confidence in the dialogue’s authenticity remains steady today. Thus, although we may not have the autograph—the original, handwritten text by the author—we have excellent reason to include the Timaeus among, and no good reason to exclude it from, those works issuing from Plato’s hand.

2. Date of Composition

No one knows exactly when Plato wrote his dialogues or their precise order of composition. Nevertheless, it has become commonplace to group them into three compositional periods: early, middle, and late. The Protagoras, for instance, is usually included among Plato’s early dialogues and, if the doxographical tradition is to be trusted, the Laws is his last. As for the Timaeus, scholars are divided. Some (for example Cherniss) include it among the late dialogues—along with the Critias, Sophist, Statesman, Philebus, and Laws—given their stylistic affinity. Others (including Owen) call attention to the Timaeus’s philosophical content—particularly its use of paradeigmata to explain predication—as evidence of an earlier dating. It is debatable, however, whether style can reliably establish a dialogue’s age. Consider, for example, the statue Laocoön and His Sons. One may ask: Is it a Greek original, a Roman original, or a Roman copy of a Greek original? Regrettably, there is little, if any, telling if style is the sole measure. A feel for style, after all, is what led Winkelmann to propose erroneously a fourth-century BCE date for the statue. Or consider another example: a mature artist who completes an unfinished work from his youth. Where does it fit in his oeuvre? Because the piece was finished late, classifying it as “early” would not be entirely fitting; but because it was started early, calling it “late” also seems mistaken. This is not to say that dating artwork is impossible, but it does suggest that knowing a work’s time of production requires knowing its method of production, which, concerning the dialogues, we know preciously little about.

Ordering the dialogues based on content is also problematic. Suppose that Plato writes three dialogues: one advancing an idea, a second expanding on that idea, and a third rejecting the more fully developed version of the idea. If we set these works side-by-side, there seems to be a progression of thought from an idea’s birth and development to its repudiation, which suggests that the dialogues were written in chronological order. Behind this thinking, however, lies an assumption: that the dialogues record Plato’s personal teachings as they emerged and evolved over time. This, admittedly, has some plausibility to it. Philosophers have been known to write dialogues for didactic purposes: Galileo’s Dialogues Concerning the Two Chief World Systems and Berkeley’s Three Dialogues between Hylas and Philonous come to mind. But the difference lies in the fact that Galileo and Berkeley, apart from dialogues, wrote treatises wherein they expressed their own thoughts in their own voices. With the exception of letters, several of which are likely spurious, Plato wrote dialogues exclusively, never once stepping out from behind his dramatis personæ. This makes attributing ideas to Plato considerably more difficult. If his purpose were to proselytize, then why did he not utilize a more direct form of discourse? It was, after all, not uncommon practice for ancient philosophers in their writings to speak for themselves. Heraclitus (Diogenes Laertius, IX. 5–6), Zeno of Elea (Plato, Parm. 127c–d) and Anaxagoras (Diogenes Laertius, II. 6; cf. Plato, Phd. 97b) all wrote books and, if the testimonia is any indication, wrote them in such a way that their voices were unmistakable. That Plato does not speak for himself suggests that his interests may have been less with dictation than with participation. Given their lively dramatic character, the dialogues act as powerful magnets, drawing us in, inviting us to listen to the conversation, to participate in the exchange, and to live the only kind of life that Socrates considered worth living. If this is what the dialogues are about—if they are more about the questions raised than about the answers given—then the Timaeus’s content will tell us little, if anything, about when it was written.

By no means do these considerations extinguish the heated debate over the Timaeus’s date of composition, but they do at least provide one with compelling reasons for thinking that rendering a decisive compositional chronology is a problem that will not soon be resolved.

There are many fine studies that may be consulted on the problems and possibilities of dating Plato’s dialogues. Excellent points of departure include Brandwood’s “Stylometry and Chronology” and Howland’s “Re-Reading Plato: The Problem of Platonic Chronology.”

3. Dramatis Personæ

a. Timaeus

Opinion has shifted over Timaeus’s historicity. The ancients (such as Cicero and Iamblichus) took him to be a real person, whereas scholars today tend to regard him as a literary invention. Be that as it may, his character, thanks to Plato’s creative genius, radiates an abundant life. Socrates introduces Timaeus as a foreigner from Locri, a town in southern Italy, praising him as a poet and sophist and as one who has managed high-ranking political offices and reached the summit in all areas of philosophy (20a). Timaeus’s philosophical credentials are reaffirmed by Critias, who honors him as an astronomer who investigates the nature of all things (27a). Philosopher, diplomat, and lyricist—Timaeus has the markings of a true polymath. These wide-ranging talents bring to mind the Republic’s philosopher-king who composes an autochthonous myth to explain human origins (414c–415c). The philosopher-statesman Timaeus will in similar fashion captivate his audience with a likely story about cosmic origins. But the philosopher-king in the Republic promulgates his story knowing it to be untrue. Does Timaeus do the same?

b. Socrates

In practically every Platonic dialogue, from beginning to end, Socrates is the guiding narrative force. Often, he lures others into discussion, leading them through dialectic to see where their thinking has gone astray. Whether he is asking questions or providing answers, Socrates is usually engaged in conversation. In the Timaeus, however, he is conspicuously silent. He invites his companions to give speeches of their own, but once they begin, he listens intently, never interrupting. There are other dialogues—the Phaedrus, Symposium, and Republic, to name a few—where Socrates demonstrates patience while listening to lengthy discourses. But Timaeus’s speech easily surpasses these in duration and ambition. Why does Socrates hold his tongue? One reason seems to be that the day before he entertained his guests with a speech (17b ff.) and now they are expected to return the favor (20b). Dressed for the occasion, he vows to “keep his peace and listen” (27a1) while he dines on his “feast of speeches” (27b7–8). Another reason for Socrates’s speech: it is not an account but a story (muthos), and thus not to be scrutinized but savored. Still, Socrates is not himself—at least, not what we come to expect. What is he up to? Or maybe one should ask: What is Plato up to in depicting Socrates as he does?

c. Critias

The identity of Critias is disputed. The name brings to mind the notorious oligarch Critias: student of Socrates, uncle of Plato, and leader of the Thirty Tyrants. But the dialogue’s dramatic date suggests that we might be dealing with someone else. By most accounts, the dialogue takes place between 429 and 408 (see Dramatic Date and Setting). At that time, Critias the oligarch (b. 460) would have been an astute man between the age of 30 and 50. The dialogue’s Critias, however, struggles to recollect basic things discussed the day before (26b) while at the same time having little difficulty recalling a story he heard “a long time ago” (26c5–6). Short-term memory loss and a robust long-term memory are qualities typically associated not with a sharp-minded, middle-aged man, but rather with someone who is elderly. Also worth noting is Critias’s remark that when he first heard the Atlantis story from his grandfather, the poems of Solon were new (21b). Even if we assume that these poems were written late in Solon’s life (d. 560), it seems strange that someone living in the mid-fifth century would think of them as new. These considerations suggest that the dialogue’s Critias is probably not the oligarch, but more likely his grandfather or someone else with the same name. If that is the case, why does Plato include a character named Critias, knowing what that name would have connoted to his Athenian audience? For 21^st century speculations on Critias’s identity, see Lampert and Planeaux “Who’s Who in Plato’s Timaeus-Critias and Why,” Welliver, Character, Plot, and Thought in Plato’s Timaeus-Critias, and Nails, The People of Plato: A Prosopography of Plato and Other Socratics.

d. Hermocrates

There is little doubt that Hermocrates is the great Syracusan diplomat and general of the Peloponnesian War, whose intelligence, courage, and experience earned him praise from Thucydides (Thuc. 6.72). At the peace conference at Gela, Hermocrates alerted the Sicilian Greeks – and at Syracuse his fellow citizens – to the imperial threat posed by Athens. Moreover, because of his effort to unify warring factions, Athens met her defeat in the Sicilian expedition. Plato’s audience would have known Hermocrates not only for his ability to induce action through speech, but also as one of the chief adversaries of imperialistic Athens. Readers should therefore note the irony when Hermocrates cajoles Critias into telling his story about ancient Athens’ effort to liberate those nations subjugated by imperialistic Atlantis (20d).

4. Dramatic Date and Setting

There is no specific mention of locale, but since Socrates receives the speeches as “guest gifts” (20c1, 27a2), it is likely that, like Timaeus and Hermocrates, Socrates is a guest at Critias’s home in Athens. As for the dialogue’s dramatic date, based on Critias’s remark that his discourse will be both payment of debt to Socrates and a tribute to the goddess on her feast-day (21a; cf. 26e), it is reasonable to think that the Timaeus takes place during one of many Athenian festivals celebrated in honor of Athena. Opinions vary as to which festival Plato has in mind. Some (such as Cornford) argue that it is either the annual (Lesser) Panathenaea or the quadrennial (Greater) Panathenaea, both of which took place in Hecatombaeon (July/August). Others (such as Taylor), who regard the events described in the Republic and Timaeus as occurring on subsequent days, argue that it must be a different Athena-centered festival (like Plynteria), since the events in the Republic take place during the Bendideia, which was celebrated in Thargelion (May/June), a full two months before the Panathenaea. Opinions regarding the year of the drama also vary: 429 (Nails), 421 (Lampert and Planeaux), 411 (Press), and 409–408 (Zuckert).

5. Narrative Structure

Apart from the characters, dramatic date, and physical setting, narrative structure is an important feature of Plato’s dialogues. Some dialogues such as the Republic, Symposium, and Phaedo are narrated. Others such as the Euthyphro, Apology, and Crito are dramatic, consisting of direct dialogue between characters without narration. Although it may seem trivial, narrative structure can have a bearing on how one reads and interprets a dialogue. Unlike a narrated dialogue, which is presented by someone who has already digested and formed an opinion about the material that he is relating to his audience, a dramatic text is free of such bias. In a narrated dialogue, however, an author can provide extra-dialogical details such as a character’s body language and tone of voice, how characters are physically oriented to one another, and a running commentary. A narrated dialogue can also have varying degrees of depth, from a narrator reporting a conversation he himself heard to a narrator reporting a conversation he heard from someone else, who might have heard it from yet another person, and so on. This depth naturally raises questions about the narrator’s credibility. This is relevant to a dialogue such as the Symposium, which Aristodemus relates to Apollodorus, who in turn relates it to his friend Glaucon, an exchange that we ourselves witness as readers. Narrative depth also plays a role in the Republic, where we find Socrates criticizing mimetic speech while practicing it as the dialogue’s narrator. As a direct drama, the Timaeus lacks narrative depth, nor is it particularly rich in dramatic discourse. Although there are dialogical passages such as the opening exchange between Socrates and Timaeus, uninterrupted speeches account for over 70 of the work’s 75 Stephanus pages. This raises a fair number of concerns, many of which pertain to Plato’s relation to the text. One may argue that by not interrupting Timaeus’s speech, Plato is giving it his assent. Why else would he allow Socrates to fade uncharacteristically into the background? It is worth noting, however, that the narrative does not end at Timaeus 92c, but continues with Critias 106a. In other words, the Timaeus and Critias are published as separate dialogues, but they form a narrative unit. Because Plato left the Critias incomplete, we have no idea how it was to end or whether, as some have speculated, Plato planned a third dialogue, the Hermocrates, to round out a trilogy. Socrates might have remained a passive observer throughout, or he might have remained temporarily silent, waiting politely for Critias to finish his speech before launching his Socratic assault. But maybe Plato left the Critias unfinished on purpose as an exercise for his audience to pick up where he left off, to bring the dialogue to a close, and to be not just passive spectators but active participants, like the characters in the dialogues, makers of philosophical discourse. Open questions abound.

6. Outline & Analysis of the Dialogue

a. Prologue, Part 1: An Invitation to Storytelling (17a–20c)

Socrates opens the dialogue with a question, although not the kind the reader expects. Rather than asking about piety, justice, or beauty—the usual Socratic fare—he enquires into the whereabouts of a missing guest. He counts those present, “One, two, three,” only to come up short: “But where is the fourth?” Timaeus attests that the guest’s absence is not intentional: “Some illness (astheneia) befell him” (17a). Nevertheless, one wonders whether Timaeus is telling the truth. Was the guest willing but unable to come, or might Timaeus be covering for someone unwilling to face Socrates? And who might this person be? Plato never reveals his identity. Theaetetus, Clitophon, and Plato himself were candidates put forward by ancient authorities (Procl. In Ti. 16–17). But a compelling case has been made in recent years for thinking that the missing guest is Alcibiades, whose absence may have had to do less with physical illness than with moral weakness (see Lampert and Planeaux). Timaeus does not say what kept the guest away, but only that it is astheneia, which could refer to either physical or moral infirmity. If moral sickness is the reason, one cannot accuse Timaeus of dishonesty. Then again, he is not completely forthcoming either, leaving ambiguous the real reason for the guest’s absence. This is not surprising given Timaeus’s own admission that he can give nothing more than an imprecise account of anything related to the physical world (29b)—a deficiency that would presumably extend to the physical or psychological condition of an absent party guest. At any rate, Timaeus, speaking for Critias and Hermocrates, assures Socrates not to worry: those who are present will repay Socrates for the gifts he so generously bestowed the day before.

Socrates’ gifts, it turns out, were speeches about the best kind of polis (17c–19a). At Timaeus’s request, Socrates rehearses his chief points. In the best polis:

1)    everyone is given one occupation suited to his or her nature;

2)    there is no gender discrimination: occupations are open to men and women alike;

3)    the artisans occupy a class separate from the guardians, who are charged with making war on behalf of the polis;

4)    the guardians, who have a spirited and philosophic nature, live communally, may not own private property, and undergo the same rigorous training regardless of gender;

5)    all marriages and child-rearing are regulated by the polis; and

6)    offspring of good citizens are reared as guardians while offspring of bad citizens are handed over to the polis to be raised presumably as artisans.

These points naturally bring to mind the Republic’s kallipolis, but what is included on the list is just as intriguing as what is excluded; for Socrates leaves untouched, among other things:

1)    the deleterious effects of poetry on the soul (Rep. 3 and 10);

2)    the search for justice and the analogy between the soul and the state (Rep. 4);

3)    the distinction between knowledge and opinion and their respective objects (Rep. 5);

4)    the metaphor of the sun, divided line, and allegory of the cave (Rep. 6 and 7);

5)    the philosopher-king and his education in mathematics and dialectic (Rep. 7); and

6)    the eventual decline and collapse of the kallipolis into tyranny (Rep. 9 and 10).

Socrates in the Timaeus paints a picture that pales in comparison to his account in the Republic, bringing to light the polis’s political foundations but disregarding the philosophical forces animating it. How strange for Socrates to assemble a political body only to leave it soulless. Equally strange is Timaeus’s reaction. Upon finishing his summary, Socrates asks whether he has omitted anything. Timaeus responds, “Not at all” (19b). Surely, this is contrary to the reader’s expectations. If, from a dramatic point of view, the Republic and Timaeus had taken place on subsequent days, Timaeus should have pointed out these omissions. What are we to make of this? One suggestion is thatTimaeus forgot parts of the discussion from the day before and answers to the best of his recollection. Or, maybe Timaeus knows Socrates left bits out, but responds as he does just to move the conversation along. Another possibility, however, is that Socrates has summarized his speech in its entirety, omitting nothing. In this case, the polis of the Timaeus is not the kallipolis of the Republic, but rather its likeness or approximation. This reading fits the rest of the drama quite well, especially when considering that the showpiece of the dialogue, Timaeus’s cosmology, is itself no more than a likely story, an approximation of the truth (29d).

Plato drives the wedge even deeper between the Republic and Timaeus by having Socrates express a desire to see his polis set in motion—like beautiful animals “moving and contending in some struggle” (19c). Contrast this with Socrates’ claim in the Republic that the kallipolis, regardless of whether it could actually come to be, would still serve as “a heavenly model for anyone who wants to see and found a polis within himself” (592b). Of course, this might be an inconsistency in Socrates’ thinking, but it might also be that he is up to his old ironic tricks. In the Republic, because Glaucon and Adeimantus were receptive to dialectic, Socrates’ traditional psychoanalytic approach of asking questions was enough to set their souls in motion. Timaeus and Critias, given their social status and alleged reputation for wisdom, would predictably be a bit more stubborn and less receptive to dialectic. For this reason, Socrates, like a behavioral psychologist, sets up a test with his speeches from the day before in order to draw from their responses insight into their natures. Just before he finishes, Socrates, as he so often does, flatters his companions, singling them out as the only living men capable of satisfying his desire (20b)—a transparent display of Socratic irony if there ever was one. Thus, the apparent inconsistency in Socrates’ thinking might be nothing more than a change in methodology. Socrates, as is so often the case, is toying with his interlocutors, using them as guinea pigs in his little experiment. One wonders whether it is for this reason that the fourth member of their party—if he is indeed Socrates’ spurned lover, Alcibiades, who had drunkenly embarrassed himself in the Symposium—failed to show.

b. Prologue, Part 2: The Story of Atlantis (20c–27b)

Hermocrates, promising to repay Socrates’ guest gifts, invites Critias to recount a story that he shared the day before. Critias first heard the story as a ten-year old from his grandfather while attending the Apaturia (21b), a three-day festival associated with hereditary groups—phratries, as they were known—which gathered to celebrate their patrilineal kinship (homopatoria) and to receive new members. A legendary border dispute between Athens and Boeotia served as the festival’s etiological backdrop—an important fact omitted by Critias. The principal figures were two combatants: the Boeotian king Xanthus (“Fair One”) and the Athenian champion Melanthus (“Dark One”). The two proved to be equals—that is, until Melanthus at one point cried out to his opponent, “You are cheating, Xanthus, for there is someone behind you!” Xanthus, distracted, whirled around and Melanthus, seizing his opportunity, dealt a fatal blow. Some versions of the story allege that Melanthus tricked Xanthus; others blame Zeus Apātenōr (“Zeus Deceiver”) or Dionysus Melanaigis (“Dionysus of the Black Goatskin”) for the ruse. All versions explain the festival’s origins with a punning etymology: the Apaturia commemorates Athen’s victory by apatē (deception). Thus, “Apaturia” would have had for Plato’s audience a dual meaning, signifying both a reception and a deception. The reader should keep this in mind when listening to Critias, for his story emulates the Apaturia: it pays respect to common origins and fraternity, yet has an element of deception insofar as it presents a distorted picture of the state that Socrates wishes to be set in motion.

Before relating his story, Critias provides some background regarding its transmission. It dates back to Solon, Critias’s distant relative, who heard it from an old priest from Sais, an Egyptian city that shared with Athens the same patron goddess (Neith/Athena, 21e). This is significant; for just as the Apaturia reunited communities with blood ties, the meeting between Solon and the Egyptian priest marks the reunion of two cultures with tutelary ties. But there is another tie worth noting, namely the intellectual kinship between Critias and the priest. From his emphasis on the story’s lineage, Critias makes known his esteem for ancient records and hearsay. The Saisian priest likewise shows his preference for ancient hearsay by criticizing Solon’s speeches about antiquities. “You are young, young in soul, all of you,” the priest tells Solon. In particular, he criticizes the Greek myth of Phaethon, describing it as a story (muthos) with no basis in empirical fact (22c–d). Socrates, of course, was critical of this type of unimaginative positivism, which in the Phaedrus he refers to as a sort of “rural wisdom” (agroika sophia, 229e). The reader may wonder whether Socrates’ companions will ever fulfill his wish. He has presented them with a lifeless state and entreated that they set it in motion, yet it seems unlikely that an appeal to the lifeless science of the Egyptians will accomplish this end. This is worth bearing in mind when listening later to Timaeus’s strange, but lively, creation story (muthos).

With the background of the story out of the way, Critias gets to the story proper, which, like the Apaturia’s etiological myth, concerns an ancient dispute. The players are Atlantis and Athens—not the Athens familiar to Solon, but rather an Athens existing some 9,000 years before. Governed by excellent laws and unsurpassed in war, Athens struggled against the imperialistic Atlantis. Although the odds were stacked against her, Athens emerged victorious, liberating nations that Atlantis had enslaved along the way (25b–c). It is worth remembering that fifth-century Athens, far from being a spirited liberator, was herself an ambitious, imperialist power. These ambitions would contribute not only to Athens’ greatness, but also to her demise. Perhaps her greatest embarrassment was the disastrous Sicilian Expedition. Shortly after deploying a massive fleet of ships and hoplites, Athens recalled the expedition’s principal proponent, Alcibiades, to stand trial for sacrilege. Rather than returning to Athens, Alcibiades fled to Sparta, where he gave his best advice on how to overcome his mother city. The Athenian war effort deteriorated rapidly. Its eventual defeat was assisted by none other than Hermocrates, who, like Melanthus, achieved victory through deception (Thuc. 7.73–4). One night, he sent associates to the Athenian camp. Pretending to be traitors, they misled the Athenians into believing that Syracusans were guarding the roads and that it would be safer to withdraw during the day. Unaware of the ruse, the Athenians lingered, giving the Syracusans time to block the escape routes and disable the Athenian ships. Days later, the expedition would end in catastrophe with thousands of retreating Athenians killed and several thousand more sold into slavery or left to die in prisons.

Permeating Critias’s speech, therefore, is the theme of deception. He not only receives the story at a festival of deception, but transmits it at a time when Athens herself would fall victim to deception. One even begins to wonder whether Critias himself should be trusted. Consider his claim that Socrates’ speech the day before “was not far off the mark from agreeing with … what Solon said” (25e). This clearly overstates the truth. Not unlike Socrates’ polis, ancient Athens was a regimented society with discrete class divisions: (1) craftsmen, (2) shepherds, hunters, and farmers, (3) warriors responsible only for executing matters of war, and (4) priests (24a–b). But here the similarities end. Socrates makes no mention of priests; and although he does separate the artisans and farmers from the warriors, he does not separate the artisans from the farmers (17c). Moreover, Critias says nothing about how ancient Athens treated its women, the moral character of its warrior class, or whether marriages and child rearing were state-regulated. Socrates’ polis and ancient Athens have much less in common than Critias suggests, which prompts the question: What is the point of Critias’s story? Why does Plato include it in the dialogue? Two reasons come to mind. One is that Plato likely intends to invoke a sense of dramatic irony. Critias ironically relates a story of Atlantis’ imperial hubris at a time in history when Athens was planning the Sicilian Expedition. To do so at the behest of Hermocrates (20d) only intensifies the irony (see Dramatis Personæ: Hermocrates). Another reason is to invite his readers to ponder how the love of glory can obstruct the pursuit of truth. Critias believes that the poleis described by Solon and Socrates are the same, but because he is so enamored with the story’s lineage, he fails to notice their differences. By inflating his reputation (doxa), Critias leaves himself vulnerable to the deceptiveness of opinion (doxa).

c. Monologue, Part 1: The Creation Story of Intellect (27c–47e)

Almost as a tease, Critias confesses that he stopped short of giving a full account of ancient Athens. If Socrates cares to hear the rest of the story, he must first listen to Timaeus, who will speak on cosmic origins and the creation of man (27a). Socrates, thrilled at his forthcoming feast of speeches, invites Timaeus to begin, requesting that he first follow custom by invoking the gods. What Timaeus does instead is peculiar. To start with, he pauses to reflect on the relevance of such an invocation, remarking that at the onset of any affair, small or great, everyone, even someone of “little prudence,” calls on some god (27c). What is to be made of this? Is it merely an incidental remark or a subtle jab at Socrates and Critias, who, having made no invocation themselves, lay bare their own imprudence? At any rate, there is an underlying irony to Timaeus’s remark: he sanctimoniously chides those who make no pious gestures, while making no pious gesture himself (27d). Instead of calling upon the gods, he calls upon ordinary men who will judge his speech (29d). Is this Plato’s way of suggesting to the reader that Timaeus is himself imprudent? Or is it that Timaeus, being a sophist, believes that there are two sets of rules: those that apply to him and those that apply to everyone else? It is difficult to say what precisely Plato intends by this, but one thing is for sure: as with Critias, the reader must guard himself against Timaeus’s potential deceptiveness.

As he begins, Timaeus lays some philosophical groundwork, discussing four issues vital to his cosmology:

1)    the metaphysical distinction between Being and Becoming;

2)    the principle that whatever comes to be does so owing to some cause;

3)    the role played by a divine craftsman or demiurge in making the cosmos; and

4)    the extent to which we can be confident that an account is true given the entities with which it is concerned.

The first of these—the Being-Becoming distinction—Timaeus introduces without hesitation or defense. There are, he says, two kinds of entities: (1) genuinely existing, un-generated and indestructible, changeless entities, which are grasped by reason together with a rational account and (2) entities that do not genuinely exist, that come to be and pass away, and that individuals form opinions about based on irrational sensation (27d–28a). Readers familiar with the Republic, Phaedo, and Symposium will recognize this as the traditional “Platonic” distinction between unchanging Forms and changing objects of everyday experience. Timaeus does not explicitly identify the first class of entities as “Forms” (ideai, eidē), but he does refer to them repeatedly as “models” or “paradigms” (paradeigmata, 28a–c, 29b, 31a, 37c, 38b–c, 39e, 48e–49a), a term that Plato uses elsewhere to denote the Forms (Euthphr. 6e, Rep. 472c, and Prm. 132c–d).

Next, Timaeus turns his attention to the cosmos, which is visible and tangible and hence something belonging to the second class of entities: those that come to be and pass away. But what caused the cosmos to be? In other dialogues, the Forms function as causes (Euthphr. 5d, 6d–e; Phd. 100b–103a, 103c–105c). In the Timaeus, the principal cause of cosmic order is the demiurge, or divine craftsman (dēmiourgos). Timaeus explains that a craftsman, when making something, bases his work on a model (paradeigma, 28a). This model, he argues, must belong to the class of unchanging things because craftsmen always intend their work to be beautiful and only an unchanging model can help craftsmen achieve this end. It is no different regarding the cosmos, which the demiurge makes by looking to “that which is grasped by reason and prudence and is in a self-same condition” (29a). As he prepares to give his account of cosmic origins, Timaeus offers a word of warning: an account concerned with changing things will always be less accurate than one concerned with unchanging things. Consider the difference between a mathematical proof and a forensic analysis: the latter, while it might be compelling, is merely probabilistic; the former, as long as one has done the calculation properly, guarantees that one has grasped the truth. Timaeus’s point is that insofar as the cosmos is itself something generated, any account pertaining to it, like a forensic analysis, can only be likely, never certain. With that in mind, he concludes, “It is fitting for us to receive the likely story (ton eikota muthon) about these things and not to search further for anything beyond it” (29d).

Socrates expresses his enthusiasm for Timaeus’s proposal, encouraging him to “perform the song (ton nomon) himself” (29d). This is an interesting choice of words. In the Republic, Socrates stresses the sovereignty of musical training, emphasizing how rhythm and harmony are able to permeate the soul and perfect it (401e). Socrates, by referring to Timaeus’s forthcoming speech as a “song,” acknowledges not only its overall significance, but also the potential impact, positive or negative, on those who are listening. Also noteworthy is Socrates’ seemingly complimentary remark, “We have received your prelude so wondrously (thaumasiōs).” The word thaumasios literally means “wonderful” or “marvelous,” which by itself seems innocuous enough, but Plato does occasionally uses it ironically (Phdr. 242a, Rep. 435c). Is this the case here? Is Socrates returning Timaeus’s earlier jab (27a), a final salvo before Timaeus begins his speech? It would certainly not be out of character for Socrates to let Timaeus know in a veiled manner, “Something is not right. I am on to you.” Plato, with his word choice, might be giving readers fair warning: something about Timaeus is not sitting well with Socrates, so his speech will be received gladly as a guest-gift should, but with the right amount of caution. It would be best for us too, as readers, to follow Socrates’ circumspect lead.

Resuming his speech, Timaeus gives a general account of how the demiurge began his work. “The god” (ho theos), as Timaeus calls him, being beautiful and intelligent, intended his creation to resemble him as much as possible (29e–30a). Onto pre-existing matter, therefore, which moved unmusically and without purpose, a rational order was imposed. Knowing the intelligent to be more beautiful than the unintelligent, the demiurge imbued the cosmic body with soul (30b). As his model, the demiurge used that living being (zōion, 30b) which embraces all living beings: “holds them within itself, just as this cosmos holds and embraces us and all the other nurslings constructed as visible” (30c–d). As for whether there is one cosmos or many, Timaeus argues against the Presocratic pluralists who posit an infinite number of kosmoi (for example, Democritus, DK 67A1). For Timaeus, because the cosmos resembles its model and its model is one in number, the cosmos too must be one in number. To create the cosmic body, the demiurge drew upon four elements—fire, air, earth and water—in equal proportion; and basing his work on a model, he created a body whole and perfect, one in number, free of old age and disease, and spherical in shape (31b, 33a–b). In addition, because the cosmic body was to be self-sufficient—in no need of anything external to it—it was made without eyes or ears, atmosphere for breathing, or organs for digestion (33c). It also lacked hands, legs, and feet; and the motion imposed on it was not directional—moving linearly in this or that direction—but rotational. The reader may rightly consider strange this so-called cosmic body, for even though it is based on a model embracing all living beings, its appearance is wholly unlike any other known living thing. But without any doubt, the strangeness does not end here.

Next comes the creation of the cosmic soul (34c–36d). This passage is notoriously difficult, as it contains a detailed account of how the demiurge fashions the substance of the soul from a mixture of pairs: (1) of the Indivisible and the Divisible and (2) of the Same and the Other. How can seemingly unmixable things like the indivisible and the divisible be mixed together? This is a puzzle that Timaeus leaves for his audience to work out. Just as puzzling is the subsequent passage on the movement of this soul according to certain mathematical ratios. Is the reader to take these passages seriously? Several ancient commentators including Aristotle, Xenocrates, and Plutarch did. Perhaps we should as well. But there is good reason to think that something else is intended, even though what that is might be somewhat obscure. For one thing, one might ask how Socrates, Critias, and Hermocrates could follow Timaeus’s incredibly complicated and arguably convoluted story. It is not as though Timaeus had visual aids—at least none of which the reader is aware. Would anyone listening to Timaeus not want some clarification? Would someone not think to ask a question or two? It is unusual for Socrates, of all persons, to not hit the pause button to engage his companion. This is not to say that Timaeus is being insincere or that he has something up his sleeve, but so much of the narrative up to this point has raised questions about trustworthiness. Perhaps there is something more devious, even diabolical, to Timaeus’s speech. Or perhaps this is being too cynical. There is much ground yet to cover.

Timaeus concludes the first part of his story by describing how the demiurge makes time (37c–38c), the planets (38c–39e), and lesser gods (39e–40b). The creation of man the demiurge delegates to these lesser gods (40d–47e, see Monologue, Part 3: The Creation Story of Man). Particularly strange is how Timaeus describes the divine revolutions of the soul. These motions, he says, are bound within a spheroform body named “head,” which is attached to a body in order to prevent it from rolling along on the ground (44d). This passage conjures up the nightmarish image of Empedoclean eyeballs rolling about on the ground in search of foreheads (DK 31B57). But it also should remind readers of the spherical humanoids featured in Aristophanes’ account of the origins of love in the Symposium. There is no questioning the ambitiousness and inventiveness of Timaeus’s story, yet its content, bordering on the absurd, makes it difficult to see it as something other than a parody. The suggestion that Timaeus is manufacturing a sort of parody becomes even more plausible in the second part of his story.

d. Monologue, Part 2: The Creation Story of Necessity (47e–69a)

The cosmos, as Timaeus’s story continues, emerges not only from an act of divine reason; it also arises from brute necessity. Because reason and necessity are cosmic co-creators, Timaeus transitions from the role played by a calculating demiurge to that of unthinking necessity. For starters, he returns to the distinction drawn earlier between Forms and sensible things, basing this metaphysical distinction now on an epistemological distinction between intellect (nous) and true opinion (doxa alēthēs). Because different epistemic states require different objects, intellect and true opinion must be drawn to different objects—Forms and sensible things, respectively (51d–e). But here he argues that there must be a third item added to the list. Children are not born from a single parent, but rather from two: a father and a mother. Thus, in addition to that which comes to be (offspring ~ sensible thing) and that from which it comes (father ~ Form), there must be something in which the created thing comes to be (mother ~ space [chōras], 52a). Note, however, how Timaeus presents his argument. He does not say that any of this is demonstrably true—that there is some intellectual compulsion to believe it. Instead, he says, “Here’s how I myself cast my vote (psēphon)” (51d). Voting is how a legislature promulgates a law or how a law court arrives at a legal decision; it is not the preferred method of arriving at scientific truth. Timaeus draws a distinction between reason and true opinion—the former immovable by persuasion, the latter alterable by persuasion—yet given that he casts a vote, how can his account be anything other than mere opinion and hence something that he, or anyone else, might be persuaded against?

What follows is yet another complicated passage—a lengthy one concerning the constitution of matter (53c–55c). This is his famous discourse on triangles. As has already been established, there are four kinds of matter—fire, air, earth, and water—and each contains particles, which, we are now told, are geometrical solids (acting as molecules) composed of elementary right triangles (acting as atoms), either isosceles or scalene. In effect, all bodies can be reduced to collections of triangles. There is little need here to spell out Timaeus’s theory in detail. Other scholars have already performed that formidable task (see, for example, Cornford, Plato’s Cosmology and Kalkavage, Plato’s Timaeus, Appendix C). Suffice it to say, what Timaeus renders, if anything, is an aesthetically pleasant picture of the physical world with all of its beautiful geometrical shapes: tetrahedrons (fire), octahedrons (air), icosahedrons (water), hexahedrons (earth), and dodecahedrons (panels for the constellations). His picture is also a lyrical one; for in a brief digression on the subject of whether the cosmos is one or many, Timaeus says, “In reasoning about all these things, someone would do so musically (emmelōs)” (55c). It is as if he considers himself to be engaged in a dramatic contest of sorts. Who can render the most compelling, the most rhapsodic, the most beautiful song? Whose story (muthos) will collect the most votes from the judges? Timaeus has already let his audience know for whom his voting stone (psēphos), if he were given one, would be cast. Others, he confesses, may cast theirs for another (55d).

As one might expect from a highly refined literary work like Timaeus’s, word play abounds. Consider, for instance, the passage where Timaeus pauses to reflect on his storytelling (59c–d). He says at first that it would not be difficult to see where his story is headed—not for anyone “who pursues the look of likely stories.” Whenever such a person puts aside or buries (katathemenos) definite accounts of the unchanging and turns to likely accounts of transient things, he permits himself a pleasure (hēdonē) and time to engage in a sort of childish play (paidian). Thus, he invites his audience to “give free rein to this very play … [and] proceed to the likelihoods next in order.” The very next sentence engages in this sort of play: water mixed with fire, which Timaeus calls “fluid” (hugron), comes from “flowing over the earth” (huper gen reon, 59d). In this way, he presents the physical derivation in terms of a linguistic one. Clearly, this is Timaeus having a bit of fun, but it is consistent with his entire speech up to this point. Not long after, he claims that fire (thermon) is hot because it minces (kermon, 62a)—yet another play on words. Timaeus’s comedic storytelling continues with his account of eating, which he describes obscurely in terms of voiding (kenōseis) and refilling (plērōsis). His subsequent accounts of tastes (64a–65b), smells (66d–67a), sounds (67a–c), and colors (67c–68d) are just as impish, often stated matter of factly without explanation regardless of how absurd they might sound to his audience. Is the reader to take these accounts seriously, or are they in fact sly Platonic parodies of the detailed, yet cold and soulless accounts popular among scientists of his day? Timaeus’s most baffling claim perhaps—at least, among his more baffling claims—is in his discussion on color mixing. Red and black, he posits, when mixed together yield green (68d). This simply does not make sense—not from a scientific point of view, at any rate. How can this be taken seriously? What precisely is Timaeus doing?

Drawing his Story of Necessity to a close, Timaeus prepares to deliver his conclusion. In doing so, he adopts a more serious tone, but there is still something strange about what he says. He begins with a metaphor: “Now that the kinds of causes have been sifted out and lie ready to hand for us, like wood for builders, out of which we must weave together the account that remains…” (69a). A reasonable response to this would be a quizzical one. Flour and grains are sifted, not wood, and Timaeus clearly knows this given what he says earlier in his story about the movement and ordering of the elements in space: “just like the particles shaken and winnowed out by sieves and other instruments used for purifying grain: the dense and heavy are swept to one site and settle, the porous and light to another” (52e). What also could he mean by weaving wood together? Such strange metaphors he uses. Timaeus continues: “Let us go back again briefly to the beginning and make our way swiftly to the same point from which we arrived there; and let us attempt to add to our story a finish and a head that’s joined to what has gone before” (69a–b). He has already returned—more literally, retreated or withdrawn (anachōrēteon, 48b)—to the beginning once, namely when he transitioned from his Story of Intellect to his Story of Necessity. Now he is proposing a second return. What is the meaning behind these reversals? Earlier in the dialogue, Timaeus refers to the retrograde motions of outer planets (36d). Are his literary reversals a way of mimicking the reversals found in nature? Storytelling, for Plato, being an art form, is a form of mimesis, after all. Timaeus is creating a story about cosmic creation. Thus, what holds for the cosmos in its coming to be should also hold for Timaeus’s cosmo-muthos, and vice versa.

e. Monologue, Part 3: The Creation Story of Man (69a–92c)

Socrates’ feast of speeches—at least the first course, served by Timaeus—is nearing its end. With the cosmos in place, Timaeus draws his story to a close by rhapsodizing on the creation of man. Earlier in his speech, he indicated that the demiurge fashioned the cosmos only up to a point; the creation of other life forms he left to other, lesser gods. Speaking to these gods, the demiurge explains that were he to create animals and plants, they would turn out as perfect as the gods themselves (41c). In that case, he would not be able to achieve his goal of realizing all levels and kinds of perfection. At first glance, this seems strange. How can a being capable of making something as enormous as the cosmos be unable to populate it with meager animals and plants? The problem, however, is not as it seems. It is not that the demiurge lacks power. On the contrary, being perfect, the demiurge always performs optimally; his actions yield only what is best. It would therefore be contrary to his nature—and, one may say, offensive to his impeccable aesthetic tastes—to make something that did not in the closest possible way resemble him in greatness and beauty. It would be tantamount to a masterful artist lowering himself to produce an amateurish painting. Creating a masterpiece is within his power; not doing so would be a shameful underachievement, unbefitting of his greatness. For this reason, the demiurge, exercising sovereignty over all things, delegates to lesser gods, who were themselves created (41b), the responsibility of creating animals and plants. Given their relative imperfection, they could do what the demiurge could not—namely, create less perfect life forms—and not disgrace themselves by doing so. By allowing them to complete what he started, the demiurge could fully realize his plan to ensure that the all (to pan) is genuinely all (hapan), full and complete, a plenitude lacking nothing (41c).

How, then, does man come to be? What is his origin and nature? Timaeus gives not one, but two accounts. The accounts do not conflict, but they do differ in length, detail, and artistry. The first appears at the end of the Story of Intellect (40d–47e). It begins with the demiurge creating the human soul from a mixture—not the same mixture from which the cosmic soul came to be, but a different one using the same ingredients blended less purely. Having combined these ingredients, the demiurge distributes bits of the mixture to the various stars (for example, lesser gods) like a farmer sowing seeds (42d). At this point, the lesser gods take over and begin fashioning the human body. Borrowing portions of the elements, the gods “went about gluing them together … with close-packed rivets invisible for their smallness” (42e–43a). It is worth noting here the difference in approach. Whereas the demiurge sows seeds, the lesser gods insert rivets. Whereas the demiurge creates with an eye to balance and beauty, the lesser gods simply get the job done by pasting things together. The demiurge uses art and agriculture to create; the gods appear to be workers on an assembly line. Note, too, how Timaeus’s account of vision reflects this same workmanlike approach. It tells how vision comes about, but not why it does beyond that it allows us to keep our soul in tune with the movements of the heavens (45b–46a, 47b). The creation of man, as related in the Story of Intellect, is much akin to the work of the lesser gods: it is practical, but not particularly meaningful. It relates the origin of man, but not his nature. In fact, it seems to serve as little more than a bridge between the Story of Intellect and the Story of Necessity. A far more robust account of man’s creation follows the Story of Necessity.

As with the account of man’s creation in the Story of Intellect, the Story of Man begins with the soul. From the start, however, the account is decidedly more lively and detailed. Timaeus opens by telling how the gods, still entrusted with the task of making man, sculpted a body around the immortal soul and housed within that body another kind of soul governed by “terrible and necessary affections” (deina kai anagkaia pathēmata): pleasure and pain, rashness and fear, anger and hope (69d). Notice that they do not rivet or glue the soul to the body, but sculpt the body around the soul. Already these lesser gods approach their job with more grace and flair than they did before. Moreover, they have enough sense to separate the two souls so that the mortal soul will not contaminate the immortal soul. They do this by placing the mortal soul within the chest and separating the chest from the head with an isthmus (namely, the neck) within which the spirited part of the soul resides. Next to be made is the heart, which communicates to other organs when an unjust deed has been committed, and after that the lungs, which cool the heart, enabling it to be more subservient to reason. The lungs, however, are not merely placed within man; they are implanted (enephuteusan, 70c). It is remarkable how the image of the gods from one story to another has changed. The Story of Intellect underplays their artistry, emphasizing instead their efficacy. The Story of Man, by contrast, draws them closer in nature and purpose to the demiurge: they are not only sculptor-like in how they shape the body around the soul, but also farmer-like in how they plant organs within the body. Also worth noting is the image of man himself. He is no longer an inert machine assembled with glue and rivets, but a dynamic organism animated by passions and emotions.

Continuing his story, Timaeus shifts his attention to the liver—one of his seemingly favorite organs. Reason and emotion have been physically separated—reason being located in the head and the appetites in the abdomen. Because the appetites cannot understand reason—evidently because they speak different languages—there was a need for a mediator to convey messages from the higher faculties to the lower (71a). This becomes the purpose of the liver. From the intellect, the liver receives images, which it projects onto its surface to frighten and restrain the appetites (72b). This is reminiscent of the Republic’s cave allegory, where prisoners passively watch as images flicker across a cave wall. Just as those images keep the prisoners pacified, the images projected by the liver keep the appetites at bay. Apart from helping the intellect control emotion, the liver also serves as the source of divination (71e, 72b). No one in his right mind, Timaeus says, has access to divine reason; yet when asleep or overcome by some inspiration, man receives divine messages, which must be reflected upon and interpreted. At no point does Timaeus condemn divination as a form of superstition or subterfuge, treating it instead with respect and sincerity—at least for those who think deeply and reason slowly about their divinations. But why does Timaeus treat divination with respect at all? Why not like the Saisian priest explain divination away naturalistically as either hallucination or huckstery? Perhaps the reason is that for Timaeus—and by extension Plato—man is not simply a patchwork of physical parts: cells, tissues, organs, and systems. Man is not a god, but he does have divine origins, a divine element within himself, and the ability to be divinely inspired. Whereas the Saisian priest ridiculed the idea of myth shedding light on the nature, Timaeus wants to preserve the link between the natural and supernatural. Far from setting man and the gods apart, Timaeus’s cosmo-muthos brings them closer together.

Much care and skill is brought to bear on the gods’ creative efforts. Consider how they make bone and flesh. It begins with marrow, which “gave the mortal kind its roots” (katerrixoun, 73b). Marrow, Timaeus tells his companions, comes from a universal seed-stuff (epephēmisen) comprised of smooth and unwarped triangles. Planted within the marrow are various kinds of souls (73c). The gods then take some of this marrow and form it into a spherical shape. This spherical field (aroura) receives the divine seed (to theion sperma) and becomes the brain (73d). Bone likewise comes to be through an intricate, creative process (73e). First, earth is sifted by the gods to be pure and smooth. Next, it is kneaded and soaked with marrow, baked in fire, dipped in water, placed back into the fire, and dipped once again in water. This is an utterly fantastic account—one that emphasizes the intelligence and imagination behind the creation of man and of his seemingly most mundane parts. Bone is created as if by a potter and flesh as if by a wax-modeler (74c). Man is not the product of necessity or blind chance; he arises from a series of deliberate actions. The gods—whether the demiurge or lesser gods—emerge as agents who care not only to complete their work, but to introduce into their products a sense of style and value. They care about what they make. Their artistic fingerprints can be found on everything from the cosmic soul to human skin, hair, and nails. But they also know how best to manipulate materials. Owing to their different shapes, the elements behave differently. Thus, by combining an artistic sensibility with a knowledge of how to engineer things given the materials at their disposal, the gods are able to imbue the cosmos and man with beauty, structural stability, and purposefulness.

To be sure, man is well-formed and beautiful, but he is also able to grow and flourish. In fact, he appears in Timaeus’s story as plant-like. In several passages, the gods act as farmers, planting organs within the human body. Marrow literally allows man, like a tree, to take root (73b). In addition, the gods equip man with an irrigation system: “[the gods] channelled through our body itself, just as they were cutting channels in gardens, so that the body might be refreshed as though from an inflowing stream” (77c–d). These channels help the “stream of nourishment” flow so that the “irrigation may be made uniform.” The gods use their agricultural knowledge frequently when creating man, who, Timaeus says, is “not an earthly but a heavenly plant” (phuton ouk eggeion alla ouranion, 90a). This naturally prompts the question: Why is so close a connection drawn between man and plants? One may think it is a joke. Anyone can tell the difference between humans and plants. Maybe Timaeus wanted to get a rise from his companions. But if it is a joke, it is not a very good one; for as most would agree, there are few things less amusing than an oft-repeated joke. A possible clue may be found just before the discussion of man’s irrigation system, where Timaeus tells a brief story about the origins of plants (70e–77c). After making man, the gods decide to create plants, unlike animals in appearance, yet having sensations and “a nature akin to man.” Plants are indeed animals, he notes, because “everything that partakes of living may justly and most correctly called an animal” (77a–b). Since plants are intended to be eaten (77c), this cannot be a solemn plea for vegetarianism. Even so, it is certainly possible that Timaeus’s message is ecological. Sometimes, because of our egocentric and homocentric concerns, we lose track of our place in the world. It would be an overstatement to suggest that Timaeus is advancing an environmentalist ethics; but his holistic view of creation, if taken seriously, does raise important questions (1) about the relationship between creator and created, that is, between planter and planted (87b), (2) about the kinship between man and nature, and (3) about how the good for man relates to the good for other living things. Rarely has Plato been considered a philosopher with ecological concerns, but perhaps a careful study of the Timaeus would help to change this opinion.

Although man is capable of flourishing, he is also subject to collapse and decay. For this reason, Timaeus pivots to the origin and nature of diseases. He uses a strange word to describe their origin, saying that they are “constructed” or “contrived” (sunistēmi, 81e). Is the implication that the gods have a hand in creating diseases? Was this to ensure the imperfection of man? Timaeus, unfortunately, leaves these questions unanswered. Instead, he launches into a discussion of diseases that specifically afflict the body. These arise from an excess, deficiency, or misplacement of elements (82a–b). In other words, there is a physical imbalance, causing a body to become unmusical (plēmmelēsēi) and out of harmony with the cosmos (82b). After bodily diseases, Timaeus turns to diseases of the soul, giving special attention to folly, which comes in two varities: stupidity and madness. Stupidity, he says, is the greatest disease, arising when a body becomes too large and the intellect too weak (88a–b). When this happens, bodily motions gain mastery, causing the soul to become dull, slow, and forgetful. But does this mean that only large people are stupid? Are small folk immune to this disease? It seems an obvious question to ask, but Timaeus does not consider it. Moving along, Timaeus traces madness to overly seeded marrow (86c–d), not to wickedness, as some do: “people hold the opinion that he’s not diseased but willingly bad. But the truth is…” (86d). Timaeus’s claim here is both Socratic and un-Socratic. It is Socratic in that it affirms that no one performs wrongful acts willingly; however, it is un-Socratic in that rather than attributing wrongdoing to ignorance, as Socrates does, Timaeus roots it in bodily disease. In fact, physical causes are responsible for madness and stupidity. As for treating disease, Timaeus prescribes physical exercise and an avoidance of medicinal drugs (89a–c). Idleness and inactivity will only make matters worse; the body must mimic the cosmos and stay in motion. In addition, a person should tune the motions in his soul by applying himself to the liberal arts and all philosophy (88c). Striking the right balance and keeping one’s mind on higher things—these, according to Timaeus, are the ingredients to a good life and healthy soul. At this point, one might wonder: Would the silent Socrates be nodding in agreement or shaking in disagreement? Perhaps he would be doing both.

This would seem like a good place for Timaeus to stop. Critias promised Socrates that Timaeus’s story would explain the origins and nature of mankind. Timaeus has clearly gone above and beyond. Not only has he explained the origins and nature of man, but he has also given his companions lessons in human anatomy and physiology and human pathology. But Timaeus is not finished yet. There is one topic left to cover: the invention of sex. One might assume that man and woman have the same origin, but that is not so. The gods created man beautiful and well-ordered, but man is prone to physical and moral decay. He is also destined to die and, as it turns out, be reincarnated. Timaeus does not say what happens to courageous and just men, but as for the cowardly and unjust, they return not as men, but as women (90e). Women are therefore derivative, being born from morally deficient men. It is hard to know what to make of this, especially in light of the fact that in Socrates’ polis—the one that Timaeus is helping to animate—men and women are social equals. The subsequent account of intercourse is likewise peculiar. The channel for releasing urine, Timaeus says, also releases marrow (that is, seed) from the brain (91b). This marrow, being imbued with soul, gives the male reproductive organ a desire for emission. As a result, male genitals have become unpersuadable and autocratic, like an irrational animal (91b–c). In other words, the love to procreate is a form of madness in which a man loses his mind—or more literally, his brain. But is this the extent of man’s erotic feelings? Eros compels physical love, but can it compel philosophy? Can it compel movement within a polis? Timaeus rounds out his speech by explaining the origins of other animals (91d–92c). Like women, they derive from deficient men: birds from light-minded men who rely overabundantly on sight in their scientific demonstrations, land animals from unphilosophical men, and fish from the stupidest men. With the cosmos now made and fully populated, Timaeus delivers his closing line, which dispenses with the puns, jokes, and tomfoolery: “having been filled up, this cosmos has come to be—a visible animal embracing visible animals, a likeness of the intelligible, a sensed god; greatest and best, most beautiful and most perfect—this one heaven being alone of its kind” (92c). So ends Timaeus’s story, but not Socrates’ feast of speeches, which continues in the Critias.

7. Concluding Remarks

What is a contemporary audience to make of Plato’s Timaeus? Is it a serious attempt at natural philosophy or a farcical parody? There is no way of settling definitively Plato’s intent in writing the dialogue. In fact, that seems to be the nature of Plato’s art in general: he always wants his readers to keep wondering, to keep asking questions, to keep returning to his texts with the hope of discovering something new and exciting. Timaeus’s speech is very much a microcosm of the world around us with its multiple layers, interlocking pieces, and abrupt movements back and forth. But it also fits in well with a recurring theme in Plato’s dialogues. Time and again, we find in the dialogues a critique of science—not just any science, but the sort of science that tends to view nature in materialistic and mechanistic terms. In the Phaedrus, for instance, Socrates describes naturalized myths as displaying “rural wisdom” (229e). Scientific naturalism is also taken to task in the Phaedo, where Socrates recounts his youthful flirtations with the natural philosophy of Anaxagoras. Reading Anaxagoras, Socrates delighted in learning details about the shape and location of the earth and various facts about the sun, the moon, and the other heavenly bodies. Socrates also shares his delight when he learned from Anaxagoras that Mind (Nous) is the ordering principle of the world. But in the end, he was left disappointed: “I thought he’d go on to take me through the best for each and the good (agathon) common to all” (98b). Anaxagoras, therefore, impressed Socrates with his explanation of how things work, but he failed to explain why they are the way that they are and why they are good. In other words, Anaxagoras’s cosmos, in Socrates’ opinion, was without value: it moved, but without any rhyme or reason. Mind controlled everything, moving things about, but why did it move things in this way instead of that? Why did it move things at all?

If there is any message to be gleaned from the Timaeus, it is that material explanations alone cannot render a clear and complete picture of the world. Recall that the dialogue begins with Socrates recounting his speech, the day before, about the best polis. Not long after, he invites his companions to set this polis in motion—like beautiful animals “moving and contending in some struggle.” By the end of the dialogue, readers are left wondering: Has Timaeus really granted Socrates’ wish? Is Socrates’ polis any more alive at the end of the dialogue than it was at the beginning? Before rushing to judgment, one must remember that the Timaeus leads directly into the fragmentary Critias, which in turn may lead into a third dialogue, the Hermocrates. It would therefore be rash to answer these questions without taking the entire, unbroken narrative into account. Even so, there does seem to be an effort by Timaeus to create a living cosmos—one with more life and vitality than what the youthful Socrates found in Anaxagoras. It is true that Timaeus’ story at times radiates absurdity and silliness. At the same time, however, it is a lively artistic creation, much like the very cosmos his story depicts. There is craftsmanship behind its creation. Moreover, the cosmos is itself a living thing with a soul. The gods, as heavenly bodies, move in accord with reason, as does the entire cosmos itself. Beauty, goodness, and life permeate the universe. This might not be a direct response to Socrates’ invitation to set his polis in motion; but it is a step in the right direction and a powerful reminder from Plato that a philosophy that sacrifices the beautiful and the good—that sacrifices spirited muthos on the cold, antiseptic altar of logos—sacrifices a vital part of reality.

8. References and Further Reading

All translations of the Timaeus in this article are by Kalkavage, Plato’s Timaeus, Newburyport, MA: Focus Publishing, 2001.

a. Standard Greek Text

• Burnet, John. “Clitopho,” “Respublica,” “Timaeus,” “Critias.” Platonis Opera, Vol. IV. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1902.
  • Critical edition of the ancient Greek text. Essential for scholarly work.

b. English Translations

• Bury, R. G. Plato: Timaeus, Critias, Cleitophon, Menexenus, Epistles, Cambridge, Mass.: Loeb Classical Library, 1960.
  • Interlinear Greek-English translation. Includes an introduction and notes. Essential for scholarly work.
• Cornford, F. M. Plato’s Cosmology, London: Routledge & Kegan Paul, 1937. Reprinted, Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing Co., 1997.
  • Good translation, although perhaps a bit dated. Includes a detailed commentary and notes.
• Jowett, Benjamin. “Timaeus,” The Collected Dialogues of Plato: Including the Letters. Eds. Edith Hamilton & Huntington Cairns, Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press, 1961.
  • Dated translation, but still useful. Part of an anthology of Plato’s complete works. Readily available online, for example, here, here, and here.
• Kalkavage, Peter. Plato’s Timaeus. Newburyport, MA: Focus Publishing, 2001.
  • Superb translation. Includes an interpretative essay, glossary, and several appendices.
• Lee, Desmond. Timaeus and Critias. Revised by Thomas Kjeller Johansen, 2008, London: Penguin Books, 1972.
  • Good translation. Includes a lengthy introduction and notes.
• Waterfield, Robin. Timaeus and Critias. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2008.
  • Good translation. Includes a lengthy introduction, summary, and explanatory notes by Andrew Gregory.
• Zeyl, Donald J. “Timaeus,” Plato: Complete Works. Ed. John M. Cooper, Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing Company, 1997.
  • Good translation. Part of an anthology of Plato’s complete works with concise introductions and notes.

c. Classic Studies

• Cherniss, H. F. “The Relation of the Timaeus to Plato’s Later Dialogues.” The American Journal of Philology, Vol. 78, No. 3 (1957): 225–266. Reprinted in Studies in Plato’s Metaphysics. Ed. R. E. Allen, London and New York: Routledge and Kegan Paul, 1965. Also in Selected Papers. Ed. Leonardo Tarán, Leiden: Brill, 1977.
  • Makes the case for placing the Timaeus in Plato’s late compositional period.
• Owen, G. E. L. “The Place of the Timaeus in Plato’s Dialogues.” The Classical Quarterly NS 3 (1953): 79–95. Reprinted in Studies in Plato’s Metaphysics. Ed. R. E. Allen, London and New York: Routledge and Kegan Paul, 1965. Also in Logic, Science and Dialectic. Ed. Martha Nussbaum. Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 1986.
  • Makes the case for placing the Timaeus in Plato’s middle compositional period.
• Taylor, A. E. A Commentary on Plato’s Timaeus. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1928. Reprinted, New York: Garland, 1967.
  • Lengthy and ambitious commentary on the dialogue. An early effort to challenge the view that the dialogue presents Plato’s own thoughts on cosmology.
• Vlastos, Gregory. “The Disorderly Motion in the Timaeus.” Studies in Plato’s Metaphysics. Ed. R. E. Allen,  London and New York: Routledge and Kegan Paul, 1965. Reprinted in Studies in Greek Philosophy, Vol. 2, ed. D. W. Graham, Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1995.
  • Considers the nature of the disorderly motion discussed at Ti. 30a, 52d–53b, 69b.
• Vlastos, Gregory. “Creation in the Timaeus: Is It a Fiction?” Studies in Plato’s Metaphysics. Ed. R. E. Allen, London and New York: Routledge and Kegan Paul, 1965b. Reprinted in Studies in Greek Philosophy, Vol. 2, ed. D. W. Graham, Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1995.
  • Follow-up to Vlastos’s essay “The Disorderly Motion in the Timaeus” in the light of Cherniss’s work.
• Vlastos, Gregory. Plato’s Universe. Seattle: University of Washington Press, 1975. Reprinted by Luc Brisson, Las Vegas: Parmenides Publishing, 2005.
  • Offers an interpretation of the Timaeus’s cosmology within the broader context of Presocratic natural philosophy. Attributes the cosmological ideas in the dialogue to Plato himself.

d. Classical Studies

The following ancient commentaries are mainly of historical and scholarly interest. Newcomers to the dialogue will likely want to consult more recent scholarship.

• Calcidius. On Plato’s Timaeus. Ed. and trans. John Magee, Cambridge: Harvard University Press, 2016.
• Plutarch. “On the Generation of the Soul in the Timaeus.” Plutarch’s Moralia, Vol. 1, Pt. 1. Ed. and trans. Harold Tarrant, Cambridge: Harvard University Press, 1976.
• Proclus. “Commentary on Plato’s Timaeus.” Vol. 1, Book 1: Proclus on the Socratic State and Atlantis. Ed. and trans. Harold Tarrant, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2007.
• Proclus. “Commentary on Plato’s Timaeus.” Vol. 2, Book 2: Proclus on the Causes of the Cosmos and its Creation. Eds. and trans. David T. Runia & Michael Share, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2009.
• Proclus. “Commentary on Plato’s Timaeus.” Vol. 3, Book 3, Part 1, Proclus on the World Soul. Ed. and trans. Dirk Baltzly, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2010.
• Proclus. “Commentary on Plato’s Timaeus.” Vol. 4, Book 3, Part 2, Proclus on the World Soul. Ed. and trans. Dirk Baltzly, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2010.
• Proclus. “Commentary on Plato’s Timaeus.” Vol. 5, Book 4: Proclus on Time and the Stars. Ed. and trans. Dirk Baltzly, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2016.
• Proclus. “Commentary on Plato’s Timaeus.” Vol. 6, Book 5: Proclus on the Gods of Generation and the Creation of Humans. Ed. and trans. Harold Tarrant, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2017.

e. Other Studies of Related Interest

• Altman, William H. F. “Reading Order and Authenticity: The Place of Theages and Cleitophon in Platonic Pedagogy.” The Electronic Journal of the International Plato Society, n 11, 2011: 1–50.
  • Argues against the orthodoxy for the authenticity of Theages and Cleitophon. Relevant to the study of Platonic authorship.
• Arieti, James A. Interpreting Plato: The Dialogues as Drama. Savage, MD: Rowman & Littlefield Publishers, Inc., 1991.
  • Offers a literary reading of eighteen dialogues, including the Timaeus. Argues that the dialogues ought to be approaches principally as dramas, not philosophical discourses.
• Brandwood, Leonard. “Stylometry and Chronology.” The Cambridge Companion to Plato. Ed. Richard Kraut, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1992.
  • Recounts attempts made by various scholars to date Plato’s dialogues using stylometry.
• Howland, Jacob. “Re-Reading Plato: The Problem of Platonic Chronology.” Phoenix, Vol. 45, No. 3 (Autumn 1991): 189–214.
  • Offers a powerful and compelling case against efforts by some scholars to arrange Plato’s dialogues chronologically.
• Ives, Charles. Socrates’ Request and the Educational Narrative of the Timaeus. Lanham, MD: Lexington Books, 2017.
  • Draws attention to the connection between Timaeus’s cosmology and Socrates’ request for a speech about war.
• Lampert, Lawrence and Planeaux, Christopher. “Who’s Who in Plato’s Timaeus-Critias and Why.” The Review of Metaphysics, Vol. 52, No. 1 (September 1998): 87–125.
  • Important examination into the characters and historical-political background of the Timaeus and Critias.
• Lovejoy, Arthur O. The Great Chain of Being: A Study of the History of an Idea. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1936.
  • Classic work in the history of ideas tracing the origin and evolution of three philosophical principles: plenitude, continuity, and graduation.
• Mohr, Richard. One Book, The Whole Universe: Plato’s Timaeus Today. Las Vegas/Zurich/Athens: Parmenides Publishing: 2010.
  • Ambitious anthology covering a broad range of topics related to the Timaeus. Derived from the Timaeus Conference at University of Illinois at Urbana–Champaign, September 2007.
• Nails, Debra. The People of Plato: A Prosopography of Plato and Other Socratics. Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing Company, 2002.
  • Meticulous study of the individuals represented in Plato’s dialogues and their relationships to one another. Essential for scholarly work.
• Parke, Herbert W. Festivals of the Athenians. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press, 1977.
  • Valuable study of the religious festivals of ancient Athens. Contains a thorough discussion of the Apaturia.
• Press, Gerald A. Plato: A Guide for the Perplexed. London & New York: Continuum, 2007.
  • Very nice introduction to Plato’s art and thought urging that the dialogues be read as both philosophical and dramatic works.
• Rutherford, R. B. The Art of Plato. Cambridge: Harvard University Press, 1995.
  • Offers a literary interpretation of the dialogues, including the Timaeus, focusing on their formal structure, language, character development, and imagery.
• Sallis, John. Chorology: On Beginning in Plato’s Timaeus. Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1999.
  • Interesting study focusing on the dialogue’s strange and mysterious “space” (chōra).
• Welliver, Warman. Character, Plot, and Thought in Plato’s Timaeus-Critias. Leiden: E. J. Brill, 1977.
  • Close and careful examination of the Timaeus’s characters and their underlying political antagonisms.
• Westra, Laura and Robinson, Thomas M. The Greeks and the Environment. Lanham, MD: Rowman & Littlefield Publishers, 1997.
  • Anthology devoted to the examination early Greek thinking on nature and ecology. Several chapters are devoted to Plato.
• Zuckert, Catherine. Plato’s Philosophers: The Coherence of the Dialogues. Chicago; University of Chicago Press, 2012.
  • Bold and ambitious interpretation of Plato’s dialogues based on their dramatic order.

Author Information

Frank Grabowski
Email: fgrabowski@rsu.edu
Rogers State University
U. S. A.

Philodemus of Gadara (c.110—c.30 B.C.E.)

Philodemus of Gadara was a poet and Epicurean philosopher who, after leaving Gadara, studied in Athens under Zeno of Sidon before moving to Italy. Once in Italy, he lived in the area around the Bay of Naples, where he belonged to a circle of Epicureans that included Siro as well as the Roman poets Vergil, L. Varius Rufus, Quintilius Varus, and Plotius Tucca. His epigrams were preserved as part of the Greek Anthology, while his prose works were discovered at the Villa of the Papyri in Herculaneum, carbonized by the first pyroclastic surge of Mount Vesuvius in 79 C.E. He wrote on a wide range of topics, including epistemology, ethics, theology, aesthetics, logic and science, and the history of philosophy, but not physics. In his works, he presents himself as an entirely orthodox Epicurean. He does so by explicating the teachings of earlier Epicureans (especially those of Epicurus, Metrodorus, Hermarchus, and Polyaenus), defending the positions of his teacher Zeno of Sidon, arguing against fellow Epicureans whom he perceives to have strayed from orthodoxy, and advancing Epicurean positions against other schools like the Academics, Peripatetics, Stoics, Cynics, and Cyrenaics. Philodemus’ works fall into two distinct categories of style. The first are works that employ a bitter and polemical style, which he uses to denigrate other philosophers. A second, smaller group, which include On Death and his works on the history of philosophy, employ a much gentler tone and were perhaps designed to appeal to a more general audience.

The discovery of Philodemus’ works at Herculaneum in the eighteenth century was initially met with disappointment, and his works were initially regarded as offering little philosophical value. The negative reception of his works started to change in the 1970s, particularly due to the efforts of Marcello Gigante. Gigante founded the Centro Internazionale per lo Studio dei Papiri Ercolanesi, where, using new scientific methods, he made sure that revised editions of texts were released. More recently even newer technologies, such as multispectral imaging, have led to even more editions. The result of clearer editions has been to show that Philodemus’ works are more innovative than once thought, especially in the areas of aesthetics and ethics. This in turn has led to a realization that Epicureans were far less dogmatic than previously believed and that they were willing to incorporate non-Epicurean views, so long as they supported the school’s core tenets.

Table of Contents

1. Life
2. Sources
   1. Epigrams
   2. Prose Works and the Material Challenges of the Scrolls
3. The Epigrams
4. Philodemus’ Philosophy and Prose Works
   1. Epicureanism
   2. On the Good King according to Homer
   3. History of Philosophy
   4. Logic, Science, and Epistemology
   5. Ethics
      1. List of Ethical Works
      2. General Background on Epicurean Ethics
      3. On Choices and Avoidances
      4. On Death
      5. On Household Economics and On Wealth
      6. On Anger
      7. On Frank Speech
   6. Theology
   7. Aesthetics
5. Influence and Legacy
6. References and Further Reading
   1. Primary Sources
   2. Secondary Sources

1. Life

Very few concrete details are known about Philodemus’ life. Strabo tells us that he was born in Gadara, a Syrian Greek city which also produced other literary, rhetorical, and philosophical figures including the following: Menippus, Meleager, Theodorus the rhetorical teacher of Tiberius, Apsines the rival of Fronto of Emesa, Oenomaus the Cynic, and Philo the mathematician. It is not known when Philodemus left Gadara or if he went directly to Athens. Once there, however, he studied Epicurean philosophy with Zeno of Sidon (head of the Epicurean school from c.100-c.75 B.C.E.), who had a great influence on Philodemus. A number of his extant works (On Frank Speech and On Anger) are notes of lectures given by Zeno, and he describes himself as a faithful student both before and after Zeno’s death (PHerc. 1005 col. XIV.6-9). Many of Philodemus’ arguments adhere to Zeno’s interpretation of Epicurean philosophy. In On Rhetoric, for example, Philodemus consistently attempts to prove the orthodoxy of his views by restating those of Zeno, who had compiled evidence from founders’ works that supported his views. Likewise, in On Signs Philodemus puts forward Zeno’s position on Epicurus’ scientific method of inference.

Philodemus most likely left Athens in the ’80s or ’70s. His reasons for leaving are unknown, but he was probably a part of the large movements of people caused by either the Mithridatic Wars of the 80s or the Asiatic campaigns of the 70s. A reference in the Suda, a 10th-century Byzantine encyclopedia, suggests that he may have spent time in Himera but was expelled during a famine and a plague, when he was thought to have brought the anger of the gods. Unfortunately, it is impossible to comment on the reference’s veracity. What is more certain, however, is that Philodemus came to Italy, where he spent the majority of his time in either Rome, or Naples, or both. Evidence from his own work On Flattery (PHerc. 312 col. XIV) places him in the region around the Bay of Naples. Likewise, his dedication of three books of On Vices to Vergil, Quintilius Varus, Varius Rufus, and Plotius Tucca provides a further indication of his connection with the various Epicurean schools around Campania.

Once in Italy, Philodemus secured the patronage of Lucius Calpurnius Piso (c.100-43 B.C.E., consul 58 B.C.E), a wealthy Roman senator and father-in-law of Julius Caesar. According to Cicero, Philodemus met Piso when Piso was an adulescens, a term which applies to any age between 15 and 30. There are four pieces of evidence for the relationship between Philodemus and Piso: 1) To Piso, Philodemus dedicated a treatise called On the Good King according to Homer. 2) In Epigram 27 (AP. 11.44), Philodemus invites Piso to an Epicurean celebration. 3) Cicero depicts their friendship in his speech Against Piso; in this work, Cicero does not name Philodemus, but Asconius’ commentary identifies the unnamed Greek as Philodemus (Asc. Pis. 68). 4) In Catullus 47, Catullus depicts the friendship between a philosopher Socration, who can be identified as Philodemus, and a figure Catullus dubs Priapus, probably Piso.

Nothing is known about Philodemus’ death, but it is posited that he died around 30 B.C.E.

2. Sources

a. Epigrams

The majority of Philodemus’ epigrams, or poems ascribed to Philodemus, have been preserved in the Greek Anthology, which is a composite of the Palatine Anthology (found in two manuscripts AP and P) and the Anthology of Planudes (APl). These both had a common source, Constantine Cephalus’ omnibus of earlier collections of Greek epigrams including the Garland of Philip, in which Philodemus’ epigrams were incorporated. Some additional epigrams were also found in a papyrus from Oxyrhynchus (POxy. 3724). David Sider’s The Epigrams of Philodemos collects 38 epigrams either definitely by Philodemus or thought to have been by Philodemus in either AP or P. It is unknown whether Philodemus published the epigrams in his lifetime. Likewise, the original order in which the epigrams were written or arranged is not known. As a result, Sider has renumbered and re-grouped them as follows: epigrams 1 to 8, the Xanthippe cycle (Xanthippe was the wife of Socrates); epigrams 9 to 26, which are erotic poems; epigrams 27 to 29, which offer reflections on life in Campania; epigrams 30 to 34, on miscellaneous topics; epigrams 35 to 36, which have been ascribed to Philodemus but whose authorship cannot be proved or disproved; epigrams 37 to 38, which are not by Philodemus, but which have been included by Sider in order to evaluate all arguments for Philodemean authorship.

b. Prose Works and the Material Challenges of the Scrolls

Philodemus’ prose works are preserved in a collection of badly burned scrolls found at Herculaneum in an area named the Villa of the Papyri, which was discovered in 1750 by the Swiss military engineer Karl Weber. The library was found two years later in October of 1752. Upon its initial discovery no one was quite sure what they had found. The scrolls were burned beyond recognition, and did not resemble the papyri scrolls found in other places, particularly Egypt. Camillo Paderni, an artist put in charge, along with some workers, initially took the charred papyri for pieces of wood, throwing some aside and burning some as firewood. Eventually, Paderni and his workers noticed the relatively uniform nature of the finds; after first thinking they were rolls of fabric or fishing net, Paderni finally realized that they had found a library. He outlined this discovery in a letter to the Royal Society of London, saying that one room

appears to have been a library, adorned with presses, inlaid with different sorts of wood, disposed in rows; at the top of which were cornices, as in our times. I was buried in this spot for more than twelve days to carry off the volumes found there; many of which were so perished, that it was impossible to remove them.

As a result of the papyri’s carbonized state, Paderni employed a technique called scorzatura totale. This involved cutting the rolls in half vertically and then scooping out the middle portion. This method left intact the outside, concave layers, but caused the loss of important information about author, title, book number, and in some cases stichometric information, all of which is usually found at the end of the scroll. It also destroyed letters on each line crossing the cut.

After Paderni, a succession of techniques was used to open the scrolls, all of which caused further damage. They included the pouring of mercury onto the scrolls, the application of rose water, and lastly the application of vegetable gas, which did nothing but cause a bad smell. After these unsuccessful attempts, King Charles asked the head of the Vatican library for help, and Padre Antonio Piaggio was brought in to open the scrolls. Piaggio employed a combination of methods to open the scrolls, sometimes together or in isolation. The first way, known as scorzatura (“husking”), was to cut the papyri into two hemicylinders (or sometimes four smaller ones). Piaggio’s cuts were shallower than Paderni’s, which left the inner piece (the midollo or “marrow”) undamaged. Each semi-circular stack was called a scorza (“bark” or “husk”). A stack was read using a technique called sfogliamento, in which a drawing (disegni) was made of each layer before it was scraped off to expose the layer below. This method preserved only the lowest, outer layer together with the midollo. The process continued until no further layers could be separated. The disegni have been an important resource for later editors, as they preserve sovraposto and sottoposto, or fragments of layers that have become stuck to the layers inside or outside of them.

The midolli could be opened by unrolling (svolgimento) them. However, they were very brittle so Piaggio devised a machine to help open them. Animal membrane was attached to the outer edge of the papyri, ribbon or string was attached to the membrane, and then the ribbon was tied to a bar set above the midollo, which by the force of its own weight was allowed slowly to unwind. A third method (sollevamento) was used when a scroll had not been cut vertically into two sections. Working inwards from the outside of the scroll, each layer of the scorze could be lifted off. This technique had the problem of sometimes lifting off more than one layer at a time. In addition, Piaggio re-numbered the scrolls that Paderni had opened without leaving a record of having done so. This led to a number of works (for example On Music and On Piety) being read back to front, an issue which has now been remedied.

After Paderni, the British Reverend John Hayter (1756-1818) was invited to Naples to supervise the work of the Officina dei Papiri. Between 1802 and 1806, he and his team opened over two hundred scrolls. Like with Paderni, transcriptions were made of over half of these scrolls. Although these too were drawn by artists who did not know Greek, Hayter had these examined by people who did. After Naples had come under the kingship of Napoleon’s brother Joseph, Hayter went to Palermo where he continued his work. Eventually he returned to England. The disegni of the scrolls Hayter opened, together with the eighteen made earlier, were taken to England by Sir William Drummond, the British Minister to Naples from 1806 to 1809, and are now called the Oxford disegni (O). Some scrolls had later drawings made in Naples (N) to replace those taken by Hayter and others were made as new papyri were opened.

No new techniques were tried until the twentieth century, when Anton Fackelmann, a librarian from Vienna, used electromagnetism, which was successful. Once the layers were separated, Fackelmann thought to apply a coating of a natural transparent resin to strengthen them. He also added juice from fresh papyrus plants to give them added flexibility. Later, between 1999 and 2011, Brigham Young University undertook multispectral imaging (MSI) of the papyri held at the Officina dei Papiri Ercolanesi in Naples. The technique, developed by NASA scientists, takes several monochrome images of the same piece of papyrus, each with a different sensor. MSI uses filters to discern nonvisible portions of the light spectrum, particularly those in the nonvisible infrared spectrum, to differentiate black ink from the blackened scrolls. By dropping out the blackness of the papyri and enhancing the black ink, which both have different reflective characteristics, it is possible to read text that was formerly not visible.

Although the multispectral images (MSI) show text that cannot be seen by the human eye, it is still necessary for editors to view the originals of the papyri scrolls. For example, the MSI appear entirely flat when in fact the papyri fragments are highly ridged. These ridges can indicate sovrapposto and sottoposto, i.e. fragments from other columns that became stuck to other layers when the scroll was opened. Examining the papyri in person is also necessary to be able to assess their physical condition and size, and to see other features discernible when viewing papyri in person. The majority of the original scrolls are still housed in Naples at the Officina dei Papiri Ercolanesi, although there are some in Oxford at the Bodleian Library, together with the disegni taken by Drummond, and in Paris. Also found at the Officina dei Papiri are disegni of scrolls opened after Hayter’s departure as well as of copies made to replace those taken to England. The Naples disegni (N) are less reliable than those taken to Oxford.

The most recent technology applied to reading the papyri from Herculaneum has been X-ray phase-contrast tomography (XPCT). The application of this technology to reading the texts from Herculaneum is in relatively early stages, and there are still some limitations associated with it. However, the use of XPCT is most promising, as it offers the major advantage of being able to read letters without needing to open the scrolls, a process which is extremely damaging.

Each work from Herculaneum will have a number, such as PHerc. 1050, which was assigned at its original opening. It will also have an English title, Latin title, and finally a Greek one. For example, PHerc. 1050 may be called by its English title, On Death, or by its Latin title, De morte, or by a Greek one, Περὶ θανάτου. Philodemean scholarship tends toward using the papyrus number and the Latin or English title. In a citation of a passage from one of Philodemus’ works, scholars will cite an abbreviated title or papyrus number, a column number, and a line number. In the case of works that have had more than one editor or with works for which different books have had different editors, then an editor’s name is included as well.

3. The Epigrams

Philodemus’ epigrams reflect earlier Hellenistic conventions of using short elegiac couplets, that is, alternating lines of dactylic hexameter and pentameter. Philodemus draws on familiar epigrammatic subject matter such as erotic and sympotic topoi. Meleager, Asclepiades, Callimachus, and other authors from Meleager’s Garland all served as his poetic models. In keeping with Hellenistic tradition, his poems frequently convey the illusion that they were composed on the spot for performance at a dinner party. Even if they actually were extemporaneous to begin with, Philodemus would have polished them for publication. That they were published in his lifetime is attested by Cicero and a number of Latin poets, who were influenced by them.

Eight of Philodemus’ extant epigrams focus on the author’s relationship with Xantho (Sider 1-8, AP 5.131, 5.80, 9.570, 11.41, 5.112, 11.34, 5.4, 10.21), recounting its origin in erotic love and its move toward the poet’s desire for marriage and lifelong partnership. Twenty-eight poems are erotic (Sider 9-26, AP 5.13, 5.115, 12.173, 5.132, 5.24, 5.123, 5.25, 5.124, 5.121, 5.114, 11.30, 5.46, 5.308, 5.126, 5.107, 12.103, 5.306, 5.120, 5.120), including a witty poem in which Philodemus uses the name Demo to pun on his name (Sider 10; AP 5.115). Three poems deal with Philodemus’ life on the Bay of Naples, including two invitation poems (one to Piso, Sider 27, AP 11.44, and a second to friends, Sider 28, AP 11.35), and one contemplates the death of a friend (Sider 29, AP 9.412).

None of the poems are strictly speaking Epicurean, although the three poems that describe life in Campania (Sider 27-29, AP 11.44, 11.35, 9.412) touch on Epicurean themes such as friendship, death, and simple food. His incorporation of Epicurean ideas is itself influenced by earlier examples, which suggests that the inclusion of Epicurean themes by Philodemus has more to do with tradition than with his Epicureanism. Asclepiades had included Epicurean tenets in his poems, Posidippus Stoic tenets, and Callimachus a variety of schools. All three writers of epigrams had employed philosophical themes in their erotic poems to depict the trials of love.

Cicero (Against Piso 70) presents Philodemus’ decision to write poems as out of keeping with Epicurean traditions, and there was a tendency in sources hostile to Epicurus and his teachings to present Epicureans as anti-intellectual and anti-poetry. In reality, Epicurus’ views on poetry were more nuanced than his opponents present them, and he probably regarded poetry as a natural and unnecessary pleasure. Philodemus’ epigrams, which give the appearance of off-the-cuff recitations, fulfill Epicurus’ requirement that the wise man not go to great effort to compose poetry.

4. Philodemus’ Philosophy and Prose Works

a. Epicureanism

Epicurus (341—271 B.C.E.) established a school of philosophy around 305/4 B.C.E. He was an atomist who held an empiricist theory of knowledge, a moderate form of ethical hedonism, and a social theory based on contractarianism. Hostile sources tend to present Epicurus as anti-intellectual, anti-political, and as a sensual hedonist. Later Epicureans had a reputation for loyalty and orthodoxy, and they sought to clarify and defend Epicurus’ views against such polemic. Philodemus is no exception, and his expositions on the topics of Epicurean logic, science, epistemology, ethics, aesthetics, and theology are often extremely polemical in style. Aside from acting as an important source for Epicurean views, Philodemus’ works also provide important evidence about other ancient philosophical schools such as the Academics, Peripatetics, Cynics, Stoics, and Cyrenaics.

An area of Epicurean doctrine that is noticeably absent from Philodemus’ extant works is that of physics, although his discussions on epistemology and theology are informed by the school’s teachings on the subject. In particular, Philodemus’ works are informed by their view that it is through the study of nature (physiologia) that it is possible to live happily, by which Epicureans meant to live in accordance with pleasure. Epicurus distinguishes between the greatest pleasure, which is absence of physical pain (aponia) and mental distress (ataraxia), and the things that bring pleasure; later sources differentiate these as katastematic and kinetic pleasures respectively, although Epicurus does not do so in his extant works. He argues that although pleasure is limited and is a static state, that it is possible to vary it (Epicurus RS 9).

Philodemus’ lack of writing on the topic of physics may reflect his Roman context, as may his great interest in ethics, politics, and aesthetics. With regard to political involvement, which Epicureans are usually depicted as advising against, Philodemus argues that some people are constitutionally inclined toward political involvement (On Rhetoric fr. XIII.1-16 Longo Auricchio) and fame (On Flattery IV.4-12). Ultimately, however, he recommends withdrawal from the many to a close circle of friends as the best means of securing happiness. The most complete account of Epicurean physics is found in Lucretius, although fragments of Epicurus’ On Nature, of which Lucretius’ On the Nature of the Universe is an adaption, have been discovered among the Herculaneum papyri.

b. On the Good King according to Homer

On the Good King according to Homer (PHerc. 1507) is an ethical text, in which Philodemus offers an account of good and bad leadership qualities, but it also showcases Philodemus’ view that the Epicurean sage is best positioned to correctly interpret poetry. The treatise was dedicated to Lucius Calpurnius Piso Caesonius. Using examples from Homer, Philodemus offers advice on how to be a good leader and how to avoid being a bad one. He shows that a good person can be an effective and profitable leader if they abide by particular moral standards. He deals with themes such as leisure time, the character and behaviors of good and bad rulers, how to deal with conspirators and discord, interpersonal relationships, social harmony, as well as military matters.

Philodemus counsels against being a tyrant or despot and ruling through fear, saying that love and respect are much more effective means of governing. He recommends the avoidance of coarse behavior and jokes, licentiousness, drunkenness, overindulgence of food, boastfulness, unnecessary anger, severity, harshness, and bitterness in favor of the recitation of tasteful poetry, self-restraint in the consumption of food and drink, a stable disposition, control over excessive emotions, mildness, fairness, and gentleness. He writes that a good leader will be a lover of victory but not of unnecessary wars, battles, or civil war, and he argues that sowing dissent among one’s followers to maintain power is ineffective. He suggests that a system of punishment (rebukes and threats) and rewards (honors rather than personal gain) are effective for keeping discipline. Good rulers, according to Philodemus, are just and apply laws that are beneficial rather than simply strict. They display clemency and are dutiful. They undertake physical and intellectual training and are able to take wise counsel. The two traits Philodemus most praises in leaders are wisdom and conciliatory justice. Of all the Homeric heroes, Philodemus presents Nestor and Odysseus as displaying the greatest number of ideal traits.

Although the work is not strictly speaking a philosophical treatise, Philodemus interprets kingship theory through the lens of Epicurean philosophy, and he privileges traits such as emotional constancy, frankness, and self-restrained enjoyment of pleasures that contribute to personal security.

c. History of Philosophy

Philodemus’ historical works can be divided into two categories: the first includes dispassionate indices of past philosophers, while the second comprises works of a more polemical style in which he discusses issues surrounding the canonical texts of the early founders, orthodoxy, and doctrinal consistency. In this group of works, Philodemus defends his own views, presenting himself as a thoroughly orthodox Epicurean.

Diogenes Laertius (10.3) records that Philodemus wrote a history of philosophy, and scholars have suggested that a number of Herculaneum papyri belong to this work. These are simple indices on the Stoics (PHerc. 1018), Academics (PHerc. 164 and 201), Epicureans (PHerc. 1780), Pre-Socratics (PHerc. 327 and 1508), and Socratics (495 and 558). They contain the names of various philosophers together with their biographical details and the names of their students. They do not include analysis of any doctrines. Philodemus’ name does not appear on any of the extant fragments, and so it is not entirely certain that they are his works.

Philodemus’ remaining works on the history of philosophy are in his more usual polemic style, which he deploys against other schools and Epicureans whom he considers as failing to adhere closely enough to the teachings of the school’s early leaders. He regards the lives and teachings of Epicurus, Metrodorus, Hermarchus, and Polyaenus as the benchmark for later followers. He tends to present himself as maintaining orthodoxy while other circles of Epicureans practice a degraded version of Epicureanism. Three extant works (Memoirs, Against the …, and On Epicurus) offer examples of Philodemus’ technique of establishing the views of the early founders. In Memoirs (PHerc. 1418 and 310), Philodemus collates letters from the first generation of the school. The work’s aim is to preserve their memories and to pass along information about their daily lives to later Epicureans. In the third of the work that has been preserved, Philodemus provides excerpts from letters on the topics of friendship, financial contributions to the school, and how correctly to praise.

In Against the … (PHerc. 1005), Philodemus appears to have a similar aim of setting forth the views of the early founders, and he stresses that a good Epicurean must know the contents of their works before they are able to undertake critical interpretation. The question of canonization is thus an important aspect of this work. He cites Zeno, his teacher, as an example of an Epicurean whose exegesis of the school’s doctrines is based on careful study of the founder’s thoughts. Philodemus also defends Epicureans from the charge of doctrinal inconsistency. The full title of this work is not known and it is not precisely clear against whom Philodemus is arguing. It is more certain, however, that the work contains an attack on Epicureans, as well as on a non-Epicurean who exploited disagreements within the school to bolster his own argument. Philodemus, rather importantly, envisages two ways of being a follower of Epicurus: the first is to live a life guided by Epicurus’ teachings but not to engage in any doctrinal exegesis. It is clear that Philodemus regards this as an option for those who lack the education to delve in depth into the school’s teachings. The second follower is able to undertake interpretation of the founder’s teachings, having completed in-depth training; sages like himself and Zeno belong to this group.

A final work in which Philodemus focuses on the history of philosophy is On Epicurus (PHerc. 1231, 1232, 1289b, and perhaps 176). The work is a eulogy to Epicurus, and similarly to Against the … and Memoirs it contains a focus on orthodoxy and canonization. On Epicurus gives a particularly good indication of Philodemus’ strong emphasis on ethics and his view that ethics needs to be grounded in “the study of nature” (physiologia). It also highlights Philodemus’ desire to present himself as an orthodox interpreter of Epicurus’ doctrines. Although Philodemus does not usually provide the philosophical underpinnings for his analysis or offer a defense of his own views, in On Epicurus he does, which makes this text, together with On Choices and Avoidances, unusual within Philodemus’ oeuvre.

d. Logic, Science, and Epistemology

Rather controversially, Epicurus argued that all sensations are true, and he posited that the sensations provide knowledge of the world. According to Epicurus (Letter to Herodotus 50), however, a process of judgment takes place about the information presented by the sensations. It is at this stage that it is possible to form false opinions. Epicurus was thus concerned to develop a theory of knowledge about sense perception, and he investigated the question of how the senses can tell us what is true or false in his work The Canon. “Canon” in Greek refers to a ruler or a yardstick, in this case a yardstick for assessing what is true or false.

Epicureans established four criteria to test whether an opinion is true or false: 1. the aisthēseis (“senses”); 2. the pathē (“feelings); and 3. prolēpeis (“preconceptions”). There is also possibly a fourth criterion of truth, which is phantasikai epibolai tēs dianoias (“presentational applications of the mind”). These criteria of truth are based on the foundations of Epicurean physics, specifically its atomism, which argues that everything is made up of atoms and void. Atoms move in the void. This activity releases a stream of atoms, which are perceived by the senses. It is possible that Epicurus classed the mind together with the traditional five senses and that later Epicureans separated it out to create the fourth criterion of truth “presentational applications of the mind.” The second criterion of truth, the pathē, plays a key role in Epicurean ethics. The pathē are the feelings of pleasure and pain, which guide all choices and avoidances. Repeated sensations, whether on the mind or the five senses, lead to prolēpseis, or preconceptions about general notions. These are used by Epicurus to solve the pain of infinite regress because they require no further proof or definition. When a concept is mentioned, a preconception is called to mind, and we conceive an imprint of the thing which has already been learnt by the senses. Through a process of analogy it is possible to form further ideas about different concepts.

On Sensations (PHerc. 19/698) touches upon Epicurean physics, and underlying the work’s theory on sensations are the following arguments: sensations are common to both the body and the soul; sensations do not have memory; the sensations are irrational; all sensations are true; and sensations can be explained by Epicurean atomic theory. However, despite the presence of Epicurean canonic claims, On Sensations is not a work of physics but one of epistemology. The initial part of the scroll was destroyed in the process of opening it, which meant that the title and author information was lost; however, based on authorial style, there is good reason to think that the work is by Philodemus. Likewise, content, style, handwriting, and papyrological features such as height, suggest that PHerc. 19 and 698 belong to the same work. The work uses the difference between sight and touch to explore the Epicurean theory of sensations. It engages with the ideas of the school’s founders (Epicurus, Metrodorus, and Polyaenus), but it also introduces new formulations of traditional Epicurean arguments in the face of criticism from other schools. This is seen, for example, in the treatise’s arguments about the unity of sensation and its rejection of the Stoic idea of katalēpsis. These arguments are not known from any other source. Likewise, the treatise’s arguments about common sensitivities are also only attested in this text.

It contains six major arguments. 1) Columns I to VII argue that there is only one sensible faculty, despite the variations that can be observed when something is perceived through sight and touch. 2) Columns IX to XVI focus on Epicurean arguments about apprehension (epaisthēsis) and “affection” (pāthos) in response to Stoic theories of apprehension (antilēpsis) and “grasping” (katalēpsis). The Stoic theory of katalēpsis is rejected in favor of the Epicurean one on the basis that apprehension and affection happen concomitantly. Epicurean pāthos thus refers to both the passive act of receiving and the knowledge that one is perceiving, that is to say objective reality and the affection of the perceiver. 3) Columns XVIII and XIX examine the relationship between time and sensation, showing that recollection of past events is not a trait of the senses. 4) In columns XX to XXVII, the treatise presents arguments about so-called “common sensitivities.” The argument seeks to demonstrate that the unique function of the individual senses can be maintained at the same time that there exists “common sense.” The columns contend that the different senses perceive the same form analogously and that the difference lies in the mode of perception. 5) The fifth argument (cols. XXVIII to XXIX) addresses the opposition between common sense and the individual senses. 6) The sixth part (cols. XXIX to XXXIV) critiques arguments made by other schools which attribute to the senses abilities that they do not possess, and it outlines exactly what each sense is capable of perceiving.

The Epicurean emphasis on sense perception raises questions about how it is possible to gain knowledge of objects and things that are not directly perceived by the senses, such as atoms, void, the gods, or a concept like justice. In On Signs (Pherc. 1065), Philodemus offers insight into Epicurean arguments on the topic of how to gain knowledge about imperceptibles (adēla) from evident things. The text is not complete, but the extant part can be divided into four sections. Section 1 criticizes the objections raised by an opponent (cols. Ia.1 to V.36) and provides Epicurean rebuttals to them (cols. XI.28 to XIX.4) with a further set of objections and replies between columns five and eleven. Section 2 presents the arguments of an Epicurean Bromius, a contemporary of Philodemus (cols. XIX.9 to XXVII.28). Part 3 gives the arguments of Demetrius Lacon (cols. XXVIII.13 to XXIX.16), a contemporary of Zeno’s whose arguments are another version of Zeno’s. Part 4 offers the perspective of an unnamed Epicurean (cols. XXIX.20 to XXXVIII.22).

The text focuses on the relationship between two phenomena: the sign and thing signified. It contrasts inference from signs with syllogistic reasoning (i.e. deduction). Philodemus argues that Epicurean inference from analogy or similarity is the only viable way to understand the relationship between two phenomena. In contrast with the method of starting with the consequent and using deduction to establish an a priori relationship between the consequent (the thing signified) and antecedent (the sign), the Epicurean theory of signs begins from the antecedent and posits an a posteriori relation between two phenomena that have similar essential qualities. The emphasis on an a posteriori connection is consistent with Epicurean empiricism, as is the method of validation, which is inconceivability (adianoesia). In an empiricist fashion, the starting point is always an observable phenomenon. If both the antecedent and its consequent are perceptible things, then they can be verified by a process of positive “attestation” (epimarturēsis) or proved false by “negative attestation” (ouk epimarturēsis). For example, when a person thinks that they see Plato approaching, but they are unsure because of the distance, it is attested that it is indeed Plato by observable phenomena once Plato comes closer. However, if it is not attested by observable phenomena, then the idea is proved false.

In the case of unobservable or non-perceptible phenomena, the process of verification is somewhat different. The starting point is still the perceptible object. However, because it is not possible to attest to something that is not empirically observable, then the only means of verifying unobserved phenomena is “not-contestation” (antimarturēsis). For example, the observable phenomenon of motion demonstrates the existence of void, because there must be space for bodies to move in. In this case, the empirically observable phenomenon motion is the starting point of the inference from similarity about void. Moreover, the existence of motion does “not contest” the existence of void. If, on the other hand, the properties of the observable object contest (antimarturētai) those of the unobservable one, then the relationship is a false one.

On Signs also outlines a process of “critical appraisal” or “empirical reasoning” called epilogismos, a process used to infer the underlying properties of unobservable phenomena. For example, it is possible to critically appraise experiences of motion to discern certain properties about motion, which then allows the inference from analogy that void exists. The text also argues that it is possible to infer from similarity a phenomenon’s properties based on the past experiences of humankind (hīstoria) and not just on direct experiences.

e. Ethics

i. List of Ethical Works

 The majority of works found in the library of the Villa of the Papyri are on Epicurean ethics. On Flattery (PHerc. 222, 223, 1082, 1675, and perhaps 1457), On Arrogance (PHerc. 1008), On Household Economics (PHerc. 1424), and On Greed (PHerc. 253) were written by the same scribal hand and constitute books of a multivolume work entitled On Vices and Their Opposing Virtues. On Slander (PHerc. Paris 2), On Beauty, and On Eros may also belong to this same larger work. On Frank Speech (PHerc. 1471) together with On Conversation (PHerc. 873), On Gratitude (PHerc. 1414), and perhaps On Wealth (PHerc. 163) belong to a second multivolume work On Characters and Types of Life. On Anger (PHerc. 182) is the best-preserved book of a larger work that probably dealt with the emotions (pathē). On Death (PHerc. 1050) preserves about a third of a 118-column treatise on the topic of death.

ii. General Background on Epicurean Ethics

As with other ancient schools of philosophy, Epicurus sought a definition of eudaimonia (“happiness,” “well-being”) that was unique to his own school, and he taught that pleasure is the best means of achieving happiness. However, Epicurus did not endorse sensual hedonism but “sober reasoning and searching for the grounds of every choice and avoidance and banishing the beliefs, from which the greatest tumult lay hold of the soul” (Epicurus Letter to Menoeceus 132). Thus Epicurean pleasure is not hedonistic but is the absence of pain (aponia) and the resulting freedom from mental anxiety (ataraxia) together, the kind of pleasure that arises from the temporary satisfaction of a natural and necessary desire. He and his followers argued that if four basic principles were followed—that what is good is easy to get, what is bad is easy to endure, and that the gods and death should not be feared—then eudaimonia could be gained.

The senses teach that pleasure is good and that pain is bad, and every decision should be referred to this. Central to Epicurean ethics is the notion of limit, and all pleasure and pain have a natural limit. It is, however, possible to vary the type of pleasure experienced through varying the things that bring pleasure. Later sources differentiate between these two ways of experiencing pleasure with the terms katastematic and kinetic.

Epicurus overtly linked desire to happiness. He divided desires into three categories: natural and necessary, natural and unnecessary, and unnatural and unnecessary. Natural desires aim at the attainment of pleasure and the avoidance of pain, while unnatural desires are based on empty beliefs about what causes pleasure and pain. Epicurus enjoins followers to assess desires on the basis of what would happen if they remain unsatisfied. If when unsatisfied they cause pain, then they are necessary. If they do not cause pain when unsatisfied, then they are unnecessary. A natural and unnecessary desire aims at some variation to pleasure, but if a desire results in an excess of pain over pleasure it becomes an unnatural and unnecessary desire.

iii. On Choices and Avoidances

The text On Choices and Avoidances (PHerc. 1251) presents many of the views just outlined. The text is incomplete, and the extant 23 columns preserve what was perhaps the peroration. Although the title and author information are no longer evident, statistical, paleographical, and stylistic reasons make it likely that Philodemus wrote this work. Further, the manner in which the author deals with topics is reminiscent of Philodemus’ other works. Philodemus himself refers to a work On Choices and Avoidances, and the subject matter of PHerc. 1251 fits with this theme. The treatise deals with the need to distinguish between different desires, pleasures, and their sources so that good choices can be made and bad ones avoided. It teaches that rational calculation is the best way to ensure a happy life, one lived in accordance with the principal that pleasure is good and pain is bad. Philodemus aims to show the utility of the tetrapharmakos (“fourfold remedy”), an easily memorized summary of four key Epicurean doctrines (do not fear the gods, do not fear death, what is good is easy to get, what is bad is easy to endure). The tetrapharmakos highlights the therapeutic role of Epicurean ethics, utilizing medical imagery to do so. Philosophy is presented as treating psychic disorders in the same way that medicines treat bodily illnesses. Philodemus uses the analogy of philosophy and medicine in other works, including On Frank Speech, while the emphasis on memorization is in keeping with Epicurus’ pedagogical strategy in his letters, in which he presents memorization as key to navigating everyday situations, stating that, regardless of a student’s level, knowledge of all Epicurean doctrines is necessary.

Philodemus demonstrates how application of the tetrapharmakos to fears of dying, superstition, the valuation of external goods, justice, illness, and the management of one’s life in general can have positive consequences. He argues (col. XIII.16) that it is necessary to draw ethical arguments from the study of nature in order for them to be complete. It is from nature that it is possible to learn that nothing is produced without cause. The treatise begins (cols. I to III) with views that do not accord with those of Epicurus, before moving onto the topic of limits (col. IV). The idea of limits is central to Epicurean ethics, which taught that both pleasure and pain are limited in duration. Philodemus summarizes those ideas here. An understanding of limits enables the easy removal of pain through the satisfaction of basic desires, which Philodemus addresses in columns V and VI. He mentions the difference between types of desires, and presents the standard division of desires into three categories: natural and necessary, natural and unnecessary, and unnatural and unnecessary. However, these columns also present an innovation, perhaps in response to criticisms from outside the school, and Philodemus makes natural the genus and necessary and unnecessary the species.

Having discussed the idea of limits, which applies to two of the tetrapharmakos (that what is good is easy to gain and what is bad is easy to endure because they are both limited), Philodemus moves on to criticizing superstitious fears (cols. VII to X) that run counter to the Epicurean view that the gods are blessed and immortal beings, unconcerned with the affairs of humans. He critiques the view of the gods as vengeful and omnipotent beings, and he examines the impact these misguided beliefs have on people’s behaviors: according to Philodemus, they make people irascible, ungrateful, hard-to-please, and ill-tempered. People who hold such beliefs bring innumerable misfortunes not only to themselves but also to their cities. In columns XI and XIII, Philodemus focuses directly on the cardinal tenets of Epicureanism as taught by nature, placing great emphasis on rational calculation based on the tetrapharmakos. He stresses the fact that it was Epicurus who correctly established the tēlos of philosophy. Column XII deals with civic and criminal law, which work on the basis that people are taught to fear punishment (either from the law or from the gods). This position runs counter to Epicurean contractarianism. Philodemus’ arguments against the view are no longer extant, but it is clear that it does not fit with the tetrapharmakos.

Column XIV offers a one-way entailment between virtues and pleasure, another departure from Epicurus who regarded there to be a mutual entailment. The column also continues with the theme of physics and its connection to ethics. The end of the column is fragmentary but concludes with a comment about desires, which leads into Philodemus’ discussion of external goods in column XV. The understanding of external goods, however, is thought to be of secondary importance to the learning of the cardinal tenets, and Philodemus only dedicates this small portion of the peroration to this topic.

Columns XVI to XX focus on the final element of the tetrapharmakos: the fear of death. Philodemus examines actions and attitudes that result from fearing death. As in the case of superstitious fears, Philodemus does not explicitly state the Epicurean argument that death should not be feared because once dead we cease to exist. He again focuses on the practical problems that arise from the fear of death, including behavioral issues (cols. XVII and XX), incompetence especially with regard to financial administration (col. XX), interpersonal issues (col. XX), procrastination (col. XIX), and laissez faire attitudes. He argues that it is stupid to wish to extend life but that it is equally stupid to want to give up (col. XVI). He presents the fear of death as causing people to give up philosophy (col. XVII) and as inhibiting the attainment of a better life (col. XVIII).

The extant portion of the treatise concludes (cols. XXI to XXIII) with a comprehensive image of the Epicurean sage. Sages do not amass money but nor do they neglect their finances. Instead, they apply the tetrapharmakos to all financial decisions. They are generous and kind to others, showing gratitude when the same attitudes are shown to them. They do not fear death, and thus always cultivate new relationships and interests. Even though they do not fear death, they never seek it and always maintain their health.

iv. On Death

Philodemus’ On Death (PHerc. 1050) appears to have a much wider audience in mind. Throughout the treatise, Philodemus shows the ways that Epicurean philosophy can help combat common fears relating to death. He deals with a range of topics including the fact that the dead lack sensation (col. I) and the fact that a long amount of time gives as much pleasure as a short amount of time (col. III). This latter idea is revisited by Philodemus frequently throughout, and he stresses that a person’s conduct during their lifetime, regardless of how long or short that may be, is more important than how they die or if they are remembered after death. For example, going unburied is not a problem except that it demonstrates a lack of friends, and having no friends while alive is unfortunate (col. XXXI). Or, a death sentence is sad if someone is guilty, because they have lived a life of pain. If someone is unjustly sentenced to death, the quality of their life is what is important, not the manner of their death (col. XXXIV). Thus, a good person can take pleasure from knowing that his death will be regretted by other good people, but he will not be concerned with whether or not enemies gloat over his death (cols. XX to XXI). To do so is irrational because one will be dead and therefore unconscious. Likewise, Philodemus has no sympathy for people who fear dying in bed rather than battle, because once again posthumous glory is irrelevant when one will no longer exist. He acknowledges that it is sad to die young, but only if it has prevented someone from attaining a certain level of philosophy (col. XVII). Other topics Philodemus addresses are the lack of good things that accompany being dead (col. II), leaving behind family members who are dependents (col. XXV), dying childless (cols. XXII to XXIV), dying away from one’s fatherland (cols. XXV to XXVI), dying in poor physical condition (col. XXIX), and death at sea (col. XXXII). In most cases, Philodemus shows that these are not legitimate fears based on the Epicurean argument that sensation is dependent on the soul’s unity with the body; once one is dead, the two both cease to exist and all sensation is lost. Yet in the case of leaving dependents in a vulnerable position, Philodemus shows great sympathy and exhorts readers to make proper arrangements to avoid this situation.

The tone of On Death is far less harsh than Philodemus’ usual style. He remonstrates with other philosophers gently and uses sympathetic language to discuss non-Epicurean fears of death. For example, in columns VII and VIII, Philodemus uses a protreptic style to persuade readers of the advantages of the Epicurean view over that of the Stoic Apollophanes. Apollophanes appears to have argued that death is accompanied by pain because atoms cannot easily separate themselves from the soul. Rather than offering a harsh or sarcastic response, Philodemus clearly and concisely explains the Epicurean position that there is no pain because atoms are very small, very smooth, and very round, which allows them to painlessly fly through the skin’s pores at death.

v. On Household Economics and On Wealth

Two of Philodemus’ treatises examine the question of finances. On Wealth (PHerc. 163) is poorly preserved, but in what remains it seems that Philodemus argued that wealth and poverty are in themselves neither good nor evil. He dismisses the Cynic view that poverty is a good, the Stoic position that only virtue is important, and the popular view that wealth is evil. He instead presents the Epicurean position that wealth is only needed in moderation, which relates to the idea that natural wealth is both easy to attain and limited.

On Household Economics (PHerc. 1424) is particularly well-preserved, and Philodemus’ arguments are likewise extremely clear. The text focuses on Epicurean money management, and Philodemus is concerned with the question of how to acquire and maintain money in a way that does not inhibit pleasure. Part of the treatise critiques the views of Xenophon (fragments II, 2, cols. A to VII) and Theophrastus (cols. VII to XII). Philodemus takes issue with the fact that Socrates in Xenophon’s work does not use everyday meanings of terms, that his arguments are ambiguous, and that he is frequently irrational. He accuses both of assigning too much importance to the role of wives (cols. II and IX) and of including irrelevant details that are not needed for managing home finances effectively. However, he does not dismiss their views out of hand, and says that it is best to borrow from others if their theories are useful (col. XXVII).

In the work’s second part (cols. XXII to XXVIII), Philodemus defends the Epicurean position of money management, and he focuses on the correct attitude toward the acquisition and maintenance of wealth. He shows that wealth is not inherently problematic but that it is the attitude of the person administering it that can give rise to problems (col. XXIV). He recognizes that it is often necessary for philosophers to work (col. XI), and against the Cynics, he argues that the sage’s attitude to wealth is that having some is better than none (col. XII and XV). In fact, he argues that, although many things cause pain when present, they cause even more pain when absent (col. XII to XIII). However, he stresses that sages will not be bound by excessive toils to attain it (col. XI, XV and XVIII). Labor is problematic because it is often driven by the end for unnatural and unnecessary wealth (col. XVI). Unlimited wealth is not worth the trouble it takes to acquire, but sages should not be so leisured that they cannot provide for themselves (col. XVI). In keeping with the central place of friendship for Epicurean circles, Philodemus cites having friends as essential to the maintenance and acquisition of wealth: he argues that they help increase wealth (cols. XIV to XXV). He recommends giving to friends in times of prosperity and need (col. XXVI). In times of adversity, he also acknowledges that it may be necessary to set aside the practice of philosophy, writing that it is still possible to enact one’s philosophical principles by putting the needs of our friends before our own.

In short, Philodemus offers advice on how to apply the hedonic calculus to financial management, advocating that all wealth be acquired and maintained in such a way that does not require excessive labor or mental stress. His list of best and worst jobs in columns XXII and XXIII is based on his argument that when undertaking activities for making money and maintaining one’s existing possessions, it is necessary to (col. XXIII.39-42) “keep in mind that the principal [activity] consists in managing one’s desires and fears.” On this basis, military and political activities are the worst way for making a living, closely followed by the art of horsemanship, which he labels ridiculous, and mining. He calls mining with one’s own hands mad and mining through the use of slaves unfortunate. He writes that farming the land oneself is miserable. These jobs all require too much labor and provide insufficient pleasure in return. He deems owning land that is farmed by slaves acceptable on the basis that it creates opportunities for philosophical discussions amongst friends. Renting out properties and owning skilled slaves is likewise acceptable, for it leaves time for philosophy. However, the best way of earning a living is from the practice of philosophy. Philodemus’ recommendation to earn money from philosophy is the first appearance of this idea in Greek literature.

vi. On Anger

On Anger (PHerc. 182) provides important evidence for Epicurean emotional theory. The Epicureans held that emotions are cognitive, because they are connected to beliefs, which together with their atomic makeup and environment, shape a person’s disposition (diathēsis). On the basis that emotions are in part caused by beliefs, Epicureans held that it is possible to cure someone’s negative emotions by altering their core beliefs—a view in keeping with a curative approach to ethics. In On Anger, Philodemus presents (col. XXXVII.17-32) the school’s theory of the emotions as midway between that of the Stoics and Peripatetics. Unlike the Stoics, Philodemus regards emotions as a natural part of human nature, and he says that feeling them is an inevitable part of being human. They must, however, be regulated. In contrast with the Peripatetics, who argued that emotions are good if they are controlled by reason, Philodemus does not think emotions per se are good, because the only good for Epicureans is pleasure. Moreover, Philodemus regards the disposition of the person experiencing the emotion of utmost importance, and so an emotion can be good if the person feeling it has a good disposition, as would the Epicurean sage. If the person feeling an emotion has a bad disposition, then the emotion itself will be bad because they hold mistaken beliefs about its cause.

In On Anger, Philodemus links emotions to desires, and emotions are an evaluative response to a situation (col. XXXVII.32-39). Philodemus thinks such responses result from a person’s beliefs, in the sense that a person will respond emotionally to a situation depending on whether they believe their desires have or have not been met. In the case of anger, a person will feel angry if they perceive a desire to have been thwarted in some way. Yet, because emotions and desires are linked for Philodemus and desires are divided into natural and empty, so too are emotions (cols. XXXVII.39-XXXVIII.10). He stipulates that anger is natural and necessary only if the anger is caused by an intentional harm to a person’s natural and necessary desires, for instance their health, life, or happiness. The person who experiences natural and necessary anger will have a good disposition. This sort of anger is of limited duration. Empty anger, on the other hand, is experienced by someone with a bad disposition and is caused when someone’s unnatural and unnecessary desires are harmed. A further difference between those who experience the two types of anger relates to punishment, and Philodemus argues that a person experiencing natural and necessary anger will never enjoy punishment (col. XLIV.17-20). They will only use it as a means to prevent further instances of harm.

vii. On Frank Speech

Philodemus’ On Frank Speech (PHerc. 1471), which comprises his notes from a lecture of Zeno’s on the topic, provides insight into the key therapeutic technique of the Epicurean school. Parrēhesia (“frank speech”) was used to cure students of ethical flaws, but it was also a guideline for interpersonal relationships between sages. Its value lies in the technique’s recognition that students learn in a variety of ways, which is reflected in the teacher’s alteration of their style of criticism depending on how their students respond to criticism and on their educational needs. So, for example, Philodemus distinguishes students who have strong personalities from those who are tender (fr. 7.1-5). Other personality types that Philodemus examines are irascible people (fr. 68-74). He also states that the practitioner of frank speech must take into account a number of variables, such as whether or not the person is thankful to receive good will (frs. 75-80, fr. 88, col. XXIXb); gender (XXIb.12-XXIIb.9); and social status (see particularly cols. XXIIb.10-XXIVa.7), and age (col. XXIVa.7-XXIVb.12). His main focus is on how to vary the style of criticism depending on the student’s disposition.

Throughout the treatise, Philodemus uses sustained medical imagery, using the language of diseases and curing to discuss the treatment of ethical flaws. Philosophers are thus like doctors who prescribe medicine (i.e. Epicurean doctrine) to cure the soul. In this Philodemus is influenced by Epicurus, who had begun the tradition of equating the Epicurean wise man’s role as a healer of the soul to the doctor who healed physical ailments. A key element of Philodemus’ medical imagery is the self-diagnosis of the student, who must first recognize their character flaws before they can be successfully treated.

In addition to helping cure students, frank speech was an integral feature of Epicurean friendship. Friends in an Epicurean community could use it to overcome fears relating to the fear of death and the gods. For Philodemus, frank speech within an Epicurean community is key for generating goodwill (col. Va.3-10) and gratitude.

Two related treatises, On Conversation (PHerc. 873) and On Gratitude (PHerc. 1414), touch on similar themes. On Conversation examines the social settings of different types of speech, the usefulness of staying silent, and contemplation. On Gratitude, like On Frank Speech, argues that gratitude is an essential element of Epicurean friendship.

f. Theology

The cornerstone of Epicurean theology is the prolēpsis (“preconception”) of the gods as blessed and immortal beings, unconcerned with the affairs of humans. The school’s insistence on the gods’ lack of interference, either positive or negative, in the lives of humans led to the charge of atheism, a charge from which Philodemus vigorously defends the school in On Piety (PHerc. 1077/1098). In this work, Philodemus devotes one part to cataloguing the views of other philosophers and poets on the gods, and he attacks the Stoics praise of them as authorities. In part 2, he provides evidence that Epicurus and his followers believed in the gods, focusing specifically on their participation in public ritual. He also cites their avoidance of political and social persecution as further proof that they are not atheists. The main theme of the text is that incorrect views about the nature of the gods lead to a range of psychological, social, and political problems, including social unrest and violence.

The work belongs to broader ancient debates about the nature of the gods, a point acknowledged by Philodemus, who comments that although most people recognize the existence of the gods, their exact nature is not generally agreed on (col. LXVI.9-16). In addition to setting forth the traditional Epicurean view of the gods (cols. XL. 9-26 and XLVI.1-11), who act as role models for Epicurean sages (col. LXXI.12-19), Philodemus also argues that participation in public ritual is an essential part of promoting social cohesion (col. XXVI.25-6) and that Epicurus and his followers took part for natural and social causes (col. XXVI.5-12). However, he also argues that it helps to bring people closer to the gods (col. XXVII.12-9). Also of interest to Philodemus is the relationship between piety and justice, and he presents the two as linked (col. LXXVIII.8-12). He argues that a person who is pious in the Epicurean sense (i.e. who holds a correct prolēpsis of the gods) will abide by natural justice, which is a contract to avoid harming each other. The role of religion in human history is a further point of examination, and Philodemus argues that the belief that gods play an active role in human affairs was propagated as a means of social control. He states that early humans correctly recognized that the gods are insusceptible to harm, but that at some point people, for their own ends, ascribed myths that instilled fear in men (cols. VIII.23-29 and LXXV.1-24). He catalogues this development in a number of columns and, in the process, he conveys the message that traditional religion is a political tool.

In addition to the Epicurean belief that the gods do not play a role in human affairs, Epicurean atomistic views were a further cause for charges of atheism. These views held that everything is composed of indestructible atoms except for the gods, who are indestructible for two reasons: 1) they can be topped up with atoms from external matter, and 2) they are composed of a material that allows atoms to pass through them. There has been some scholarly debate as to whether or not Epicureans held an idealist or realist view of the gods. If they held an idealist view of the gods, then this meant that the gods were thought constructs, which could not be perceived by the senses. Instead, people had an innate knowledge of them. If Epicureans held a realist view of the gods, then they thought the gods were real beings that emit eidōla (“effluences” emitted by compounds of atoms).

Philodemus clearly thinks that the gods are real beings. In On the Gods III (PHerc. 157/152), he discusses the unique corporeal nature of the gods (frs. 5-13). He examines friendship among the gods (frs. 82-85, 87, 89), where the gods live (cols. VIII-X), how they move (cols. X-XI), whether or not they have furniture and instruments (col. XI), whether or not they sleep (col. XI), and the fact that they speak Greek (col. XIII). Philodemus also addresses the issue of how wrong views of the gods causes fear, including fear of the future. He reiterates the orthodox Epicurean position that the gods are not omnipotent, saying that they only have control over themselves. Likewise, he defends the Epicurean positions that any liability to pain would destroy their happiness and that the gods act as behavioral ideals.

The main theme of On the Gods I (PHerc. 26) is that a false belief in the nature of the gods, and the connected fear of death, is a major stumbling block to the ataraxia needed for Epicurean pleasure. The early columns of the text, although very poorly preserved, appear to target a group of fellow Epicureans who have wavered on the central position that the gods do not interfere in human affairs (col. I). Philodemus puts forward the orthodox Epicurean belief that the gods are eternally happy, immortal beings whose very nature stops their involvement in human affairs, because doing so would upset their tranquility (col. II.9-15). The better-preserved portion of the treatise outlines two main arguments: one (cols. X-XV), whether humans or animals experience worse mental disturbance (tarachē); Philodemus denies the commonly held view that animals are happier because they do not believe in the gods. Instead, says Philodemus, they are unhappier, because, unlike humans who possess reason, they can never reason their way to a happier state of being. The second argument (cols. XVII-XXIV) is whether fear of the gods or death is worse. To this, Philodemus suggests that both fears are equally bad, because they are closely connected: people usually fear death because they fear punishment by the gods after death. He argues against both fears on two fronts. Firstly, he says that if you eradicate the false notion that the gods will harm you after death by realizing that they cause neither pleasure nor pain, then the fear of death will also stop. Secondly, he writes that you will cease to fear death if you understand the Epicurean view that death is final and that you will feel nothing once you have died.

g. Aesthetics

Ancient critics of Epicurus were fond of depicting him as anti-intellectual. In so doing, they could point to Epicurus’ own statements that paideia, the main system of liberal arts education in the Hellenistic period, held no value for the aspiring philosopher. In reality, Epicurus’ statements on the topic were more nuanced, and Philodemus’ discussions on rhetoric, poetry, and music make this clear. Despite the little evidence that remains for Epicurus’, or his successors’, views on these topics, it is almost certain that they wrote on these topics and that Philodemus’ own works engage with their views. Yet, these extant Herculaneum treatises do not just show a later Epicurean’s ability to clarify the viewpoints of the founders, but they also offer further demonstration of the school’s ability to respond to contemporary debates and discourses. In three separate works On Rhetoric (book 1 PHerc. 1427; book 2 PHerc. 1674/1672; book 3 PHerc. 1426, first draft 1506; book 4 PHerc. 1423, 1007/1673; book 8 PHerc. 832/1015; book 9 PHerc. 1004; book 10 PHerc. 1669), On Poems (book 1 PHerc.466, 444, 1073, 1074a, 1081a; book 2 PHerc. 1074b, 1677a, 1081b, 1676, 994; book 3 PHerc. 1087, 1403, 1113a; book 4 PHerc. 207; book 5 PHerc. 1581, 403, 407, 228, 1425, 1538), and On Music (PHerc. 1497), Philodemus presents different ancient attitudes towards these areas. Although these works are heavily polemical, it is possible to reconstruct Philodemus’ own arguments on aesthetic theory.

Epicurean epistemology and physics form the basis of Philodemus’ theory, and he holds that sensory organs cannot make judgments about rhetoric, poetry, and music because they are irrational. Likewise, the pleasure brought about by speaking, poetry, and music is irrational. A speech, a poem, or a piece of music is judged by dianoia (“thought”). Also underlying Philodemus’ discussion of aesthetics is a theory of art or technē. The technai were an integral part of paideia, and Philodemus’ theory of art engages with broader debates about what constitutes the arts or an art. For Philodemus, an art is a skill that can be taught by method and teaching and that results in a particular atomic arrangement that affects an individual’s diathesis (“disposition”). This in turn makes the person practicing the art more effective than someone who has not had the same training. In brief, Philodemus defines a technē as the practical knowledge of a set of rules and principals. They involve training, skill, and a certain disposition. The result should be something that is not obtainable by an untrained novice. On the basis of this definition, Philodemus argues that sophistic rhetoric, but not political or forensic, is an art.

In On Rhetoric, Philodemus argues, in keeping with his teacher Zeno’s position, that only sophistic rhetoric, which he says is the art of writing speeches and composing display pieces (II.23.33-24.33), is an art, but that political and forensic rhetoric are not. This position rests on the fact that sophistic rhetors have greater success than political or forensic orators at accomplishing their goal of giving good speeches. Sophistic rhetoric is, moreover, something that can be taught because it follows a methodology. The work begins in book 1 with a discussion of different views on the technicity of rhetoric. Philodemus cites the views of non-Epicureans as well as a group of Rhodians who held that no rhetoric could be considered an art. Philodemus presents all of these views as contrary to the school’s founders. Book 2 continues with a polemic concerning the technicity of rhetoric but also offers a defense of Zeno’s view that sophistic rhetoric is an art. He discusses the difference between exact arts (grammar, music, poetry, and painting) and conjectural arts (piloting a ship, medicinal). Book 3 argues against the Stoic Diogenes of Babylon on the relationship between rhetoric, philosophy, and politics, and Philodemus says that sophistic rhetoric cannot produce politicians. Book 4 focuses on rhetorical style, and Philodemus privileges style and delivery over arrangement and invention. In contrast to Cicero, who highlights the role of the orator and privileges practical rhetoric, by arguing that all other arts service oratory (On Oratory 2.2.5 and 3.19.72), Philodemus presents a range of other disciplines as supporting oratory. Book 8 assesses and dismisses the theory of Nausiphanes that natural philosophy creates good speakers. It also attacks Aristotle for giving politics a prominent place in philosophy. Book 9 examines the utility of rhetoric, and book 10 treats other views that rhetoric is more useful than philosophy.

On Poems engages with many similar themes to On Rhetoric. In On Rhetoric, Philodemus examines the questions “what is rhetoric?” and “is it an art?” In On Poems he asks “what is a good poem?” He presents poetry as an art, specifically the art of writing a good poem. Poetry is also an art because poets follow a methodology that can be taught and learned, with the latter meaning that the learner’s atomic disposition is affected by the process. In keeping with Epicurus and the other founders’ views, Philodemus holds that poems have no educational value and that they offer neither knowledge nor ethics. Neither does poetry have any utility; this is the preserve of prose. Philodemus, however, is predominantly interested in the aesthetic question of what makes a poem good. His answer is that a good poem is a mixture of form and content, where form refers to versified words and content refers to the thoughts of the poem. The form is specific to poetry, in the sense that the poet is the only artist to write in meter. Form and content are mutually dependent: the content of a poem cannot be expressed without words, but equally words are meaningless without content, which is a poem’s subject matter. In this Philodemus adheres to the Epicurean theory of language, which holds that words, as opposed to sounds devoid of meaning, involve reasoning (epilogismos). A good poem, then, is good based on its artful composition and its content, although that content will be neither useful nor moral. Moreover, a poet whose disposition has been transformed by training in the art of poetry will more successfully compose a poem than an untrained individual, although Philodemus does not regard a poem’s genre as important: a poem of any genre can be good. A good poem will also generate further thoughts in the audience. Philodemus thus judges poetry purely on its entertainment value and a good poem rests on the poet’s ability. Only philosophy written in prose can argue a point. Poetry, however, is not harmful, especially to Epicureans who hold correct opinions and can thus read a poem for pleasure without being influenced by any incorrect information. Moreover, a sage can be a poet, so long as they use technē to achieve the proper goal of writing a good poem and so long as the writing of poetry is subordinate to their philosophical goals.

On Poems follows Philodemus’ usual habit of argumentation, and it is a polemical work, in which he does not put forward a positive view. Books 1 and 2 heavily criticize euphonists, who argued that sound gives poetry value. Due to the Epicurean view that the senses are irrational, Philodemus strenuously argued against euphony. Book 3 discusses the relationship between euphony and meaning, and the difference between poetic and prosaic words. Book 4 examines the question of genre, while book 5 looks at how poetry actually works and considers the evaluation of a poem’s quality.

Of the three arts, Philodemus is the most ambivalent about music, probably because its aural nature is difficult to reconcile with Epicurean views that the senses are irrational. He recognizes that music can be pleasing. However, unlike poetry, which uses words to convey thoughts, music cannot communicate. Philodemus’ main target is the Stoic Diogenes of Babylon, who argued that music can teach virtues. In contrast, Philodemus argues that the pleasure of listening to music can distract the listener from the content of any accompanying lyrics. Music, like poetry, is a natural but unnecessary pleasure.

5. Influence and Legacy

Philodemus’ philosophical influence was minimal either due to the lack of circulation of his work or due to the Epicurean school’s orthodoxy, which tended to look back to the school’s founders. It seems reasonably certain that Philodemus’ On Frank Criticism influenced Horace’s Satires and perhaps Horace’s interest in Epicureanism more broadly. On Piety may have influenced the structure of Cicero’s On the Nature of the Gods, although it is also possible that they both had a common source. The situation with Sextus Empiricus’ discussion of paideia in Against the Mathematicians 1-6 is similar, and it seems clear that either Philodemus was a source for Sextus or that the two authors shared the same source material. Cicero cites Philodemus, together with a fellow Epicurean Siro, as authorities in On Moral Ends (2.119). The only direct reference to one of Philodemus’ works is by Diogenes Laertius (10.3), who refers to his compilation on the history of philosophy. The influence of Philodemus’ epigram 23 on Catullus 13 is clear. There has been some discussion of his poetic theory’s influence on Augustan poets, especially on their interest in highly-wrought poetic styles.

6. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

There is no single edition containing the full collection of Philodemus’ works. Here is a list of revised editions of the original Greek texts, accompanied by introductory discussions that outline the work’s content, the history of its papyrus, and a commentary. The list is not complete, but it does offer the majority of editions.

• Amoroso, Filippo. “Filodemo sulla conversazione.” Cronache Ercolanesi, vol. 5, 1975, pp. 63-76.
• Angeli, Anna. Agli amici di scuola. Bibliopolis, 1988.
• Capasso, Mario. “L’intellettuale e il suo re (Filodemo, L’adulazione, Pherc. 1675, Col. V 21-31).” Studi di egittologia e di papirologia, vol. 2, 2004, pp. 47-52.
• Chandler, Clive. Philodemus on Rhetoric. Books 1 and 2: Translation and Exegetical Essays. Routledge, 2006.
• De Lacy, Phillip, and Estelle Allen De Lacy. Philodemus: On Methods of Inference. Bibliopolis, 1978.
• Del Mastro, Gianluca. “Il Pherc. 1004: Filodemo, De rhetorica VII.” Zeitschrift für Papyrologie und Epigraphik, vol. 182, 2012, pp. 131-133.
• Diels, Hermann. Philodemos Über die Götter. Erstes Buch. Verlag der Königl. Akademie der Wissenschaften, 1916.
• Diels, Hermann. Philodemos Über die Götter. Drittes Buch. Verlag der Königl. Akademie der Wissenschaften, 1917.
• Dorandi, Tiziano. “Filodemo, Gli Stoici (Pherc. 155 e 339).” Cronache Ercolanesi, vol. 12, 1982, pp. 91-133.
• Dorandi, Tiziano. Storia dei filosofi: Platone e l’academia. Bibliopolis, 1991.
• Dorandi, Tiziano. Filodemo, Storia dei filosofi. La Stoà da Zenone a Panezio. Brill, 1994.
• Dorandi, Tiziano, and Emidio Spinelli. “Un libro di Filodemo sull’avarizia?” Cronache Ercolanesi, vol. 20, 1990, pp. 53-59.
• Essler, Holger. “Un nuovo frammento di Ermarco nel PHerc. 152/157 (Filodemo, De dis, libro III).” Cronache Ercolanesi, vol. 35, 2005, pp. 53-59.
• Essler, Holger. “Falsche Götter bei Philodem (DI III KOL. 8,5-KOL. 10,6.)” Cronache Ercolanesi, vol. 39, 2009, pp. 161-205.
• Fish, Jeffrey. “Philodemus, De Bono Rege Secundum Homerum: A Critical Text with Commentary (Cols. 21-39).” University of Texas at Austin, 1999.
• Fish, Jeffrey. “Philodemus’ on the Good King According to Homer, Columns 21-31.” Cronache Ercolanesi, vol. 32, 2002, pp. 187-232.
• Fish, Jeffrey. “The Closing Columns of Philodemus’ on the Good King According to Homer, Pherc. 1507, Cols. 95-98 (= Cols. 40-43 Dorandi).” Cronache Ercolanesi, vol. 46, 2016, pp. 55-81.
• Gargiulo, Tristano. “Pherc. 222: Filodemo sull’adulazione.” Cronache Ercolanesi, vol. 11, 1981, pp. 103-127.
• Giuliano, Fabio Massimo. “Pherc. 495-Pherc. 558 (Filodemo, Storia Di Socrate E Della Sua Scuola?): Edizione, commento, questioni compositive e attributive.” Cronache Ercolanesi, vol. 31, 2001, pp. 37-79.
• Guerra, Tepedino A. “Filodemo sulla gratitudine.” Cronache Ercolanesi, vol. 7, 1977, pp. 93-113.
• Guerra, Tepedino A. “Il primo libro ‘Sulla Ricchezza’ di Filodemo.” Cronache Ercolanesi, vol. 8, 1978, pp. 52-95.
• Guerra, Tepedino A. “Il Pherc. 1678: Filodemo Sull’invidia?”  Cronache Ercolanesi, vol. 15, 1985, pp. 113-125.
• Hammerstaedt, J. “Der Schlußteil Von Philodems Drittem Buch Über Rhetorik.” Cronache Ercolanesi, vol. 22, 1992, pp. 9-117.
• Henry, W. Benjamin. Philodemus, On Death. Society of Biblical Literature, 2009.
• Indelli, Giovanni. L’ira. Bibliopolis, 1988.
• Indelli, Giovanni, and Voula Tsouna-McKirahan.  [Philodemus, ] [On Choices and Avoidances]. Bibliopolis, 1995.
• Janko, Richard. Philodemus, On Poems. Oxford University Press, 2000.
• Janko, Richard. Philodemus, On Poems, Books 3-4, with the Fragments of Aristotle, on Poets. Oxford University Press, 2010.
• Jensen, Christian Cornelius. Peri Kakion Liber Decimus. Teubner, 1911.
• Konstan, David, et al. Philodemus, On Frank Criticism. Society of Biblical Literature, 1998.
• Longo Auricchio, Francesca. “Frammenti inediti di un libro della ‘Retorica’ di Filodemo (Pherc. 463).” Cronache Ercolanesi, vol. 12, 1982, pp. 67-83.
• Méndez, Acosta E., and Anna Angeli. Filodemo. Testimonianze su Socrate. Bibliopolis, 1992.
• Militello, Cesira. Memorie Epicuree. Bibliopolis, 1997.
• Monet, Annick. “[Philodème, Sur les sensations] Pherc. 19/698.” Cronache Ercolanesi, vol. 26, 1996, pp. 27-126.
• Obbink, Dirk. Philodemus, On Piety Part 1. Oxford University Press, 1996.
• Olivieri, Alessandro. Philodemi Peri Tou Kath’ Omeron Agathou Basileôs Libellus. Teubner, 1909.
• Scott, Walter. Fragmenta Herculanensia: A Descriptive Catalogue of the Oxford Copies of the Herculaneum Rolls Together with the Texts of Several Papyri Accompanied by Facsimiles. Clarendon Press, 1885.
• Sider, David. The Epigrams of Philodemos: Introduction, Text, and Commentary. Oxford University Press, 1997.
• Sudhaus, Siegfried. Philodemi volumina rhetorica. Teubner, 1892-1896.
• Tsouna, Voula. Philodemus, On Property Management. Society of Biblical Literature, 2012.

b. Secondary Sources

• Annas, Julia. “Epicurean Emotions.” Greek, Roman, and Byzantine Studies, vol. 30, no. 2, 1989, pp. 145-164.
  • Annas shows the usefulness of Philodemus’ On Anger for reconstructing Epicurean emotional theory.
• Armstrong, David, et al. Vergil, Philodemus, and the Augustans. University of Texas Press, 2004.
  • An edited collection that seeks connections between Philodemus’ works and Augustan poets, especially Vergil.
• Asmis, Elizabeth. “Philodemus’s Poetic Theory and ‘On the Good King According to Homer’.” Classical Antiquity, vol. 10, no. 1, 1991, pp. 1-45.
  • Asmis argues that Philodemus presents poetry has having no utility, i.e. the art of writing poetry has no utility. Instead, any utility poetry may have comes from the wise man’s ability to interpret it.
• Auvray-Assays, Clara, and Daniel Delattre. Cicéron Et Philodème. La Polémique En Philosophie. Éditions Rue d’Ulm, 2001.
  • This edited collection provides discussion on Philodemus’ ethical, theological, and aesthetic treatises.
• Erler, Michael. “Der Zorn Des Helden. Philodemus ‘De Ira’ Und Vergils Konzept Des Zorns in Der ‘Aeneis’.” Pompeii Bibliography and Mapping Project, vol. 18, 1992, pp. 103-126.
  • Erler shows the connections between Philodemus’ theory of anger and Vergil’s Aeneid.
• Fish, Jeffrey, and Kirk R. Sanders. Epicurus and the Epicurean Tradition. Cambridge University Press, 2011.
  • This edited collection covers a range of topics using historical, philosophical, and literary approaches. It is not a work principally focused on Philodemus, but he is utilized as a source in each chapter and some chapters are specifically focused on him. There are chapters on Epicurean pedagogy, theology, political theory, and emotions.
• Fitzgerald, John T., et al. Philodemus and the New Testament World. Brill, 2004.
  • An edited collection on the themes of frank criticism, rhetoric, and economics by classicists and New Testament scholars.
• Giannantoni, Gabrielle, and Marcello Gigante. Epicureismo Greco e Romano: Atti del congresso internazionale, Napoli, 19-26 Maggio 1993. Bibiliopolis, 1996.
  • This edited collection is not specifically on Philodemus, but it offers papers from scholars who have worked on the Herculaneum papyri and there are specific chapters on Philodemus.
• Gigante, Marcello. Philodemus in Italy: The Books from Herculaneum. Translated by Dirk Obbink. The University of Michigan Press, 1995.
  • One of the rare monographs on Philodemus, Gigante reconstructs details about Philodemus’ life, provides background information about the excavations at Herculaneum and attitudes towards Philodemus, outlines the content of Philodemus’ works alongside the state of the texts, and discusses Piso and Philodemus’ relationship.
• Monet, Annick. Le Jardin Romain: Épicurisme et Poésie à Rome. Presses de l’Université Charles-de-Gaulle, 2003.
  • This is an edited collection that interprets Philodemus’ works, along with Lucretius’ De natura deorum, within a Roman context, approaching the topic in a variety of ways ranging from finding possible direct connections between Philodemus, Lucretius, and Cicero to looking at the influences of Philodemus and Lucretius on later sources.
• Obbink, Dirk. Philodemus and Poetry: Poetic Theory and Practice in Lucretius, Philodemus, and Horace. Oxford University Press, 1995.
  • This edited collection clarifies Philodemus’ definition of art and poetry, and it shows the importance of Philodemus’ contribution to poetic theory.
• Tsouna, Voula. The Ethics of Philodemus. Oxford University Press, 2007.
  • Tsouna offers a philosophical discussion of Philodemus’ ethical treatises and provides useful information about the condition of his ethical works.

Author Information

Sonya Wurster
Email: swurster@unimelb.edu.au
The University of Melbourne
Australia