Epistemic Justification

We often believe what we are told by our parents, friends, doctors, and news reporters. We often believe what we see, taste, and smell. We hold beliefs about the past, the present, and the future. Do we have a right to hold any of these beliefs? Are any supported by evidence? Should we continue to hold them, or should we discard some? These questions are evaluative. They ask whether our beliefs meet a standard that renders them fitting, right, or reasonable for us to hold. One prominent standard is epistemic justification.

Very generally, justification is the right standing of an action, person, or attitude with respect to some standard of evaluation. For example, a person’s actions might be justified under the law, or a person might be justified before God.

Epistemic justification (from episteme, the Greek word for knowledge) is the right standing of a person’s beliefs with respect to knowledge, though there is some disagreement about what that means precisely. Some argue that right standing refers to whether the beliefs are more likely to be true. Others argue that it refers to whether they are more likely to be knowledge. Still others argue that it refers to whether those beliefs were formed or are held in a responsible or virtuous manner.

Because of its evaluative role, justification is often used synonymously with rationality. There are, however, many types of rationality, some of which are not about a belief’s epistemic status and some of which are not about beliefs at all. So, while it is intuitive to say a justified belief is a rational belief, it is also intuitive to say that a person is rational for holding a justified belief. This article focuses on theories of epistemic justification and sets aside their relationship to rationality.

In addition to being an evaluative concept, many philosophers hold that justification is normative. Having justified beliefs is better, in some sense, than having unjustified beliefs, and determining whether a belief is justified tells us whether we should, should not, or may believe a proposition. But this normative role is controversial, and some philosophers have rejected it for a more naturalistic, or science-based, role. Naturalistic theories focus less on belief-forming decisions—decisions from a subject’s own perspective—and more on describing, from an objective point of view, the relationship between belief-forming mechanisms and reality.

Regardless of whether justification refers to right belief or responsible belief, or whether it plays a normative or naturalistic role, it is still predominantly regarded as essential for knowledge. This article introduces some of the questions that motivate theories of epistemic justification, explains the goals that a successful theory must accomplish, and surveys the most widely discussed versions of these theories.

Table of Contents

1. Starting Points
   1. The Dilemma of Inferential Justification
   2. Explaining How Beliefs are Justified
   3. Explaining the Role of Justification
   4. Explaining Why Justification is Valuable
   5. Justification and Knowledge
2. Internalist Foundationalism
   1. Basic Beliefs
   2. Arguments For and Against Foundationalism
3. Internalist Coherentism
   1. Varieties of Coherence
   2. Objections to Coherentism
4. Infinitism
   1. Arguments for Infinitism
   2. Objections to Qualified Infinitism
5. Types of Internalism and Objections
   1. Accessibilism and Mentalism
   2. Objections to Internalism
6. The Gettier Era
   1. The History of the Gettier Problem
   2. Responses to the Gettier Problem
7. Externalist Foundationalism
   1. Externalism, Foundationalism, and the DIJ
   2. Reliabilism
   3. Objections to Externalism
8. Justification as Virtue
   1. Virtue Reliabilism
   2. Virtue Responsibilism
   3. Objections to Virtue Epistemology
9. The Value of Justification
   1. The Truth Goal
   2. Alternatives to the Truth Goal
   3. Objections to the Polyvalent View
   4. Rejections of the Truth Goal
10. Conclusion
11. References and Further Reading

1. Starting Points

Consider your simplest, most obvious beliefs: the color of the sky, the date of your birth, what chocolate tastes like. Are these beliefs justified for you? What would explain the rightness or fittingness of these beliefs? One prominent account of justification is that a belief is justified for a person only if she has a good reason for holding it. If you were to ask me why I believe the sky is blue and I were to answer that I am just guessing or that my horoscope told me, you would likely not consider either a good reason. In either case, I am not justified in believing the sky is blue, even if it really is blue. However, if I were to say, instead, that I remember seeing the sky as blue or that I am currently seeing that it is blue, you would likely think better of my reason. So, having good reasons is a very natural explanation of how our beliefs are justified.

Further, the possibility that my belief that the sky is blue is not justified, even if it is true that the sky is blue, suggests that justification is more than simply having a true belief. All of my beliefs may be true, but if I obtained them accidentally or by faulty reasoning, then they are not justified for me; if I am seeking knowledge, I have no right to hold them. Further still, true belief may not even be necessary for justification. If I understand Newtonian physics, and if Newton’s arguments seem right to me, and if all contemporary physicists testify that Newtonian physics is true, it is plausible to think that my belief that it is true is justified, even if Einstein will eventually show that Newton and I are wrong. We can imagine this was the situation of many physicists in the late 1700s. If this is right, justification is fallible—it is possible to be justified in believing false propositions. Though some philosophers have, in the past, rejected fallibilism about justification, it is now widely accepted. Having good reasons, it turns out, does not guarantee having true beliefs.

But the idea that justification is a matter of having good reasons faces a serious obstacle. Normally, when we give reasons for a belief, we cite other beliefs. Take, for example, the proposition, “The cat is on the mat.” If you believe it and are asked why, you might offer the following beliefs to support it:

1. I see that the cat is on the mat.

2. Seeing that X implies that X.

Together, these seem to constitute a good reason for believing the proposition:

3. The cat is on the mat.

But does this mean that proposition 3 is epistemically justified for you? Even if the combination of propositions 1 and 2 counts as a good reason to believe 3, proposition 3 is not justified unless both 1 and 2 are also justified. Do we have good reasons for believing 1 and 2? If not, then according to the good reasons account of justification, propositions 1 and 2 are unjustified, which means that 3 is unjustified. If we do have good reasons for believing 1 and 2, do we have good reasons for believing those propositions? How long does our chain of good reasons have to be before even one belief is justified? These questions lead to a classic dilemma.

a. The Dilemma of Inferential Justification

For simplicity, let’s focus on proposition 1: I see that the cat is on the mat.

Horn A: If there are no good reasons to believe proposition 1, then proposition 1 is unjustified, which means 3 is unjustified.

Horn B: If there is a good reason to believe proposition 1, say proposition 1_a, then either 1_a is unjustified or we need another belief, proposition 1_b, to justify 1_a. If this process continues infinitely, then 1 is ultimately unjustified, and, therefore, 3 is unjustified.

Either way, proposition 3 is unjustified.

Horn A of the dilemma is the problem of skepticism about justification. If our most obvious beliefs are unjustified, then no belief derived from them is justified; and if no belief is justified, we are left with an extreme form of skepticism. Horn B of the dilemma is called the regress problem. If every reason we offer requires a reason that also requires a reason, and so on, infinitely, then no belief is ultimately justified.

Both of these problems assume that all justification involves inferring beliefs from one or more other beliefs, so let’s call these two problems the dilemma of inferential justification (DIJ). And let’s call the assumption that all justification involves inference from other beliefs the inferential assumption (also called the doxastic assumption, Pollock 1986: 19).

Responses to this dilemma typically take one of two forms. On one hand, we might embrace Horn A, which is, in effect, to adopt skepticism and eschew any further attempts to justify our beliefs. This is the classic route of the Pyrrhonian skeptics, such as Sextus Empiricus, and some later Academic skeptics, such as Arcesilaus. (For more on these views, see Ancient Greek Skepticism.)

On the other hand, we might offer an explanation of how beliefs can be justified in spite of the dilemma. In other words, we might offer an account of epistemic justification that resolves the dilemma, either by constructing a third, less problematic option or by showing that Horn B is not as troublesome as philosophers have traditionally supposed. This non-skeptical route is the majority position and the focus of the remainder of this article.

Philosophers tend to agree that any adequate account of epistemic justification—that is, an account that resolves the dilemma—must do at least three things: (1) explain how a belief comes to be justified for a person, (2) explain what role justification plays in our belief systems, and (3) explain what makes justification valuable in a way that is not merely practically or aesthetically valuable.

b. Explaining How Beliefs are Justified

One of the central aims of theories of epistemic justification is to explain how a person’s beliefs come to be justified in a way that resolves the DIJ. Those who accept the inferential assumption argue either that a belief is justified if it coheres with—that is, stands in mutual support with—the whole set of a person’s beliefs (coherentism) or that an infinite chain of sequentially supported beliefs is not as problematic as philosophers have claimed (infinitism).

Among those who reject the inferential assumption, some argue that justification is grounded in special beliefs, called basic beliefs, that are either obviously true or supported by non-belief states, such as perceptions (foundationalism). Others who reject the inferential assumption argue that justification is either a function of the quality of the mechanisms by which beliefs are formed (externalism) or at least partly a function of certain qualities or virtues of the believer (virtue epistemology).

In addition to resolving the DIJ, theories of justification must explain what it is about forming or holding a belief that justifies it in order to explain how a belief is justified. Some argue that justification is a matter of a person’s mental states: a belief is justified only if a person has conscious access to beliefs and evidence that support it (internalism). Others argue that justification is a matter of a belief’s origin or the mechanisms that produce it: a belief is justified only if it was formed in a way that makes the belief likely to be true (externalism), whether through an appropriate connection with the state of affairs the belief is about or through reliable processes. The former view is called internalism because the justifying reasons—whether beliefs, experiences, testimony, and so forth—are internal mental states, that is, states consciously available to a person. The latter view is called externalism because the justifying states are outside a person’s immediate mental access; they are relationships between a person’s belief states and the states of the world outside the believer’s mental states (see Internalism and Externalism in Epistemology).

c. Explaining the Role of Justification

A second central aim of epistemology is to identify and explain the role that justification plays in our belief-forming behavior. Some argue that justification is required for the practical work of having responsible beliefs. Having certain reasons makes it possible for us to choose well which beliefs to form and hold and which to reject. This is called the guidance model of justification. Some philosophers who accept the guidance model, like René Descartes and W. K. Clifford, pair it with a strongly normative role according to which justification is a matter of fulfilling epistemic obligations. This combination is sometimes called the guidance-deontological model of justification, where “deontology” refers to one’s duties with respect to believing. Other epistemologists reject the guidance and guidance-deontological models for more descriptive models. Justification, according to these philosophers, is simply a feature of our psychology, and though our minds form beliefs more effectively under some circumstances than others, the conditions necessary for forming justified beliefs are outside of our access and control. This objective, naturalistic model of justification has it that our understanding of justification should be informed, in large part, by psychology and cognitive science.

d. Explaining Why Justification is Valuable

A third central aim of theories of justification is to explain why justification is epistemically valuable. Some epistemologists argue that justification is crucial for avoiding error and increasing our store of knowledge. Others argue that knowledge is more complicated than attaining true beliefs in the right way and that part of the value of knowledge is that it makes the knower better off. These philosophers are less interested in the truth-goal in its unqualified sense; they are more interested in intellectual virtues that position a person to be a proficient knower, virtues such as intellectual courage and honesty, openness to new evidence, creativity, and humility. Though justification increases the likelihood of knowledge under some circumstances, we may rarely be in those circumstances or may be unable to recognize when we are; nevertheless, these philosophers suggest, there is a fitting way of believing regardless of whether we are in those circumstances.

A minority of epistemologists reject any connection between justification and knowledge or virtue. Instead, they focus either on whether a belief fits into an objective theory about the world or whether a belief is useful for attaining our many and diverse cognitive goals. An example of the former involves focusing solely on the causal relationship between a person’s beliefs and the world; if knowledge is produced directly by the world, the concept of justification drops out (for example, Alvin Goldman, 1967). Other philosophers, whom we might call relativists and pragmatists, argue that epistemic value is best explained in terms of what most concerns us in practice.

Debates surrounding these three primary aims inspire many others. There are questions about the sources of justification: Is all evidence experiential, or is some non-experiential? Are memory and testimony reliable sources of evidence? And there are additional questions about how justification is established and overturned: How strong does a reason have to be before a belief is justified? What sort of contrary, or defeating, reasons can overturn a belief’s justification? In what follows, we look at the strengths and weaknesses of prominent theories of justification in light of the three aims just outlined, leaving these secondary questions to more detailed studies.

e. Justification and Knowledge

The type of knowledge primarily at issue in discussions of justification is knowledge that a proposition is true, or propositional knowledge. Propositional knowledge stands in contrast with knowledge of how to do something, or practical knowledge. (For more on this distinction, see Knowledge.) Traditionally, three conditions must be met in order for a person to know a proposition—say, “The cat is on the mat.”

First, the proposition must be true; there must actually be a state of affairs expressed by the proposition in order for the proposition to be known. Second, that person must believe the proposition, that is, she must mentally assent to its truth. And third, her belief that the proposition is true must be justified for her. Knowledge, according to this traditional account, is justified true belief (JTB). And though philosophers still largely accept that justification is necessary for knowledge, it turns out to be difficult to explain precisely how justification contributes to knowing.

Historically, philosophers regarded the relationship between justification and knowledge as strong. In Plato’s Meno, Socrates suggests that justification “tethers” true belief “with chains of reasons why” (97A-98A, trans. Holbo and Waring, 2002). This idea of tethering came to mean that justification—when one is genuinely justified—guarantees or significantly increases the likelihood that a belief is true, and, therefore, we can tell directly when we know a proposition. But a series of articles in the 1960s and 1970s demonstrated that this strong view is mistaken; justification, even for true beliefs, can be a matter of luck. For example, imagine the following three things are truth: (1) it is three o’clock, (2) the normally reliable clock on the wall reads three o’clock, and (3) you believe it is three o’clock because the clock on the wall says so. But if the clock is broken, even though you are justified in believing it is three o’clock, you are not justified in a way that constitutes knowledge. You got lucky; you looked at the clock at precisely the time it corresponded with reality, but its correspondence was not due to the clock’s reliability. Therefore, your justified true belief seems not to be an instance of knowledge. This sort of example is characteristic of what I call the Gettier Era (§6). During the Gettier Era, philosophers were pressed to revise or reject the traditional relationship.

In response, some have maintained that the relationship between justification and knowledge is strong, but they modify the concept justification in attempt to avoid lucky true beliefs. Others argue that the relationship is weaker than traditionally supposed—something is needed to increase the likelihood that a belief is knowledge, and justification is part of that, but justification is primarily about responsible belief. Still others argue that whether we can tell we are justified is irrelevant; justification is a truth-conducive relationship between our beliefs and the world, and we need not be able to tell, at least not directly, whether we are justified. The Gettier Era (§6) precipitated a number of changes in the conversation about justification’s relationship to knowledge, and these remain important to contemporary discussions of justification. But before we consider these developments, we address the DIJ.

2. Internalist Foundationalism

One way of resolving the DIJ is to reject the inferential assumption, that is, to reject the claim that all justification involves inference from other beliefs. The most prominent way of doing this while avoiding skepticism is to show that all chains of good inference culminate at a unique kind of belief called a basic belief. Basic beliefs are beliefs that need not be inferred from any other beliefs in order to be justified. This approach to resolving the dilemma is called foundationalism because basic beliefs serve as a foundation on which all other justified beliefs are supported; a person’s beliefs are related to one another like the parts of a building: beliefs justified by inference are analogous to the roof and walls, which are in turn supported by foundational basic beliefs (see Figure 1).

Foundationalism comprises a family of views, all of which claim, at minimum, that all justified beliefs are either basic or inferred from other justified beliefs. Classically, foundationalists combine this view with the claims that we can know whether a belief is justified—that is, whether it stands in an evidential chain that starts with a basic belief—and the claim that knowing whether we are justified helps us fulfill our epistemic duties—in other words, we do well when we form or keep beliefs that are well supported and discard or refuse beliefs that are not; we do poorly when we do not.

The view that justification is a matter of having certain internal mental states is called internalism, and the family of views that include both is called internalist foundationalism. There is a further debate among internalists as to whether justification requires simply having certain mental states (propositional justification) or whether justified beliefs must be based on those mental states (doxastic justification). Philosophers who reject internalism are called externalists (see §7 of this article). Another debate among internalists is whether justification helps us to fulfill epistemic duties—that is, it tells us which beliefs are epistemically permissible, obligatory, or impermissible (the deontological conception of justification)—or whether it is simply a descriptive fact about our belief systems. (For an example of the latter, see Conee and Feldman 2004).

Figure 1: Simple Foundationalist Justification. The dots represent beliefs; the arrowsrepresent inferential relations.

a. Basic Beliefs

It is one thing to say basic beliefs resolve the DIJ and quite another thing to explain how they do. René Descartes famously argued that some beliefs are basic because they are indubitable. If a belief is genuinely indubitable, Descartes argued, it cannot be false. As it is commonly understood, dubitability is a psychological, not epistemic, matter. It might be indubitable for me that my mother loves me, even if it is not true and even if it is the sort of belief that could be doubted, even perhaps by me. But Descartes used “indubitable” to describe a belief that is clear and distinct, which is supposed to guarantee that the belief is true. (See Harry Frankfurt, 1973 for a fuller discussion of clarity and distinctness.) Other foundationalists have explained how some beliefs might stop the regress in virtue of self-evidence, or their privileged role in our belief-forming systems, or their incorrigibility.

Long before Descartes, simple mathematical propositions, such as 2 + 2 = 4, and logical propositions, such as “no one is taller than herself,” were thought to be so obvious that they could not be false. These propositions, many claimed, are self-evidently true, that is, they need no supporting evidence because any attempt to support them would be weaker than their intuitive truth. Some philosophers include perceptual experiences among self-evident beliefs, experiences such as seeing red and hearing a ringing sound. Even if you misperceive a color or a sound, or misperceive what seems to be colored or what seems to be ringing, you cannot doubt that you are having the experience of seeing redness or hearing ringing.

Another explanation for why some beliefs are basic is that they play a privileged role in our belief-forming systems. A common example of beliefs privileged in this way are those formed on the basis of sensory perception: seeing a red ball, touching what feels like a rough surface, hearing a bell. You could be hallucinating these experiences, so it is not self-evident that there is a ball, bell, or surface to experience. Nevertheless, the world impresses itself on you in this way, and it would be difficult to imagine functioning without any sense perceptions whatsoever; they play a highly privileged role in our belief systems and, therefore, can justify other beliefs (hence the emphasis that scientists have traditionally placed on observation).

Further candidates for basicality are beliefs that are true in virtue of being believed, that is, if you believe them, they are true. For example, propositions about intentional states (in other words, states about a mental state, such as hoping, doubting, thinking, believing, and so forth), logically imply the existence of the subject who is in the state. So, for anyone who, while thinking, believes the proposition “I think” can logically infer “I exist.” Beliefs that if held are true are called incorrigible. Other examples may include beliefs about introspective states such as what you believe or feel or remember. If incorrigible beliefs can be recognized as true without appeal to any other beliefs, they are good candidates for justifying other, non-basic beliefs.

Unfortunately, it is not easy to see how all of our many and various non-basic justified beliefs can be inferred from this relatively small set of basic beliefs, even if we accepted every type of basic belief just mentioned. For example, imagine you have been looking for your laptop computer. When you find it, you form the belief, “There’s my laptop.” Did seeing your computer elicit the basic belief, “I seem to be perceiving a laptop there,” from which you then inferred the belief “There’s my laptop”? Not obviously. Seeing the laptop allowed you directly—without any reasoning at all—to form the belief that you found your laptop.

Examples like these have motivated some foundationalists to expand their accounts of basic beliefs to include a wider variety of experiences. These weaker accounts allow that there are many types of non-inferentially justified beliefs, all of which are at least properly basic, where “properly basic” means a belief that is either basic in the classic sense or that meets some other condition that makes it non-inferentially justified for a person. As long as there are a sufficient number of properly basic beliefs, these philosophers argue, a certain sort of foundationalism remains plausible.

One example of how proper basicality might work is Alvin Plantinga’s (1983; 1993a) argument for the rationality of religious belief. Plantinga’s notion of proper basicality is supposed to be weak enough to avoid problems with classic basic beliefs but strong enough to avoid the DIJ. According to him, if a belief is properly basic for a person, it is rational for that person to accept it without appealing to other reasons. He uses rational instead of justified to distance himself from classical problems. (Sometimes Plantinga puts it even more weakly, such that, if a belief is properly basic for a person, that person is not irrational in holding it.) As an example, Plantinga argues that if a person is raised in a religious community where the central religious claims he hears are corroborated by the community and none of those claims is undermined by contrary experience or argument, he is not violating any epistemic duty in believing that, say, God exists. His experiences and circumstances can “call forth belief in God” in a way that does not require other beliefs and can serve as a reason to accept other beliefs (1983: 81). This is a controversial view, not least because it either changes the discussion from justification to rationality or conflates justification and rationality. Nevertheless, basic beliefs are controversial no matter how they are characterized, and Plantinga’s proper basicality is just one among several. For another attempt to defend classical foundationalism against objections, see Timothy McGrew (1995).

b. Arguments For and Against Foundationalism

Foundationalism has remained competitive in the history of justification largely because of its intuitive advantages over competing views. The most common argument for foundationalism is the positive argument that it explains how we actually form beliefs on the basis of evidence. I believe the sky is blue because I see that it is blue, not because I infer it from other beliefs about the sky. Roderick Chisholm offers a sophisticated version of this argument, concluding that “[t]hinking and believing provide us with paradigm cases of the directly evident” (1966: 28). In addition to this positive argument, foundationalists offer the negative argument that no alternative account—skepticism, coherentism, or infinitism—has the resources to satisfactorily resolve the DIJ, that is, to avoid both skepticism and an infinite regress (see BonJour and Sosa 2003). This is, perhaps, the more powerful of the arguments and merits some attention.

Skepticism motivated epistemologists to inquire into justification in the first place, so the skeptical option is generally considered a loss. As an alternative, coherentists (§3) maintain that a person’s beliefs are justified in virtue of their relationship to the person’s belief set (see Lehrer 1974). If a belief stands or can stand in a consistent, mutually supportive relationship with other beliefs—a “web of belief,” as W. V. O. Quine (1970) calls it—that belief is justified. However, there is reason to believe that, since all beliefs stand in mutually supportive relationships, at least some beliefs (perhaps all) will play an indispensable role in their own support, rendering any coherentist argument viciously circular. Since circular arguments are fallacious, if coherentism entails that justification is circular, coherentism cannot resolve the DIJ.

A more recent alternative to skepticism is infinitism (see §4), according to which all justified beliefs stand in infinite chains of inferential relations (see Klein 2005). Skepticism is avoided because every belief is justified by some other belief. Unfortunately, infinitism requires that we accept one of two questionable assumptions: either that there simply is an infinite number of justifying beliefs available (and to which our minds, in virtue of being finite, do not have access) or that there is some algorithm that, for any belief, B, can direct us to a non-circular justifying belief for B. The problem with the former assumption is that it seems to depend on faith that there is an infinite series of justifiers, which is not obviously better than having no justification at all. And the problem with the latter is that it comes dangerously close to foundationalism, where the algorithm functions as a basic belief. If the infinitist cannot refute these objections, it cannot resolve the DIJ.

These are simple concerns about coherentism and infinitism, and we consider more sophisticated objections in sections 3 and 4. But, if neither coherentism nor infinitism can provide an alternative means of resolving the original dilemma, foundationalism may be the most promising alternative to skepticism. Unfortunately for foundationalists, even if they are right that some account of basic belief would adequately resolve the dilemma of inferential justification, it is not clear that such an account is currently available. Further, there are at least two other serious objections to foundationalism.

First, there is some concern that foundationalism cannot be justified by its own account of justification, that is, foundationalism is self-defeating. Alvin Plantinga (1993b) offers a version of this objection. According to foundationalists, a belief is justified if and only if it is either basic or inferred from other justified beliefs. This criterion, though, is not itself basic on any classical conception of basic beliefs (indubitability, self-evidence, evident to the senses, or incorrigibility), and it is not clear how it could be supported by other justified beliefs.

One straightforward response to this objection is that the arguments above (the positive argument and the negative argument by elimination), do provide, contra Plantinga, inferential support for foundationalism. In fact, Plantinga (1983; 1993) expands his own notion of proper basicality precisely to avoid the self-defeat objection. Further, if sophisticated reasoning strategies like induction could be justified on foundationalist grounds, then foundationalism itself may be justified on such grounds. For example, Laurence BonJour (1998) defends rational insight as a basic source of evidence and then argues that induction is justified by rational insight. If foundationalism is roughly correct and there are arguments grounded in rational insight that justify foundationalism, foundationalism might be vindicated. Of course, there remain concerns about the circularity of such arguments.

Other philosophers use an inference to the best explanation to defend a type of basic evidence, though these views may rightly be regarded as hybrids of foundationalism and coherentism. For example, Earl Conee and Richard Feldman (2008) argue that “[p]erceptual experiences can contribute toward the justification of propositions about the world when the propositions are part of the best explanation of those experiences that is available to the person.” The idea that what have been called basic beliefs are connected with the world and how we are positioned in the world is a better explanation of why we have the evidence we have than traditional accounts of justification. Catherine Z. Elgin (2005) offers a similar account, arguing that, while perceptions have “initial tenability” given their privileged role in our belief formation, they do not obtain this tenability in isolation from our whole evidential context; over time, certain perceptual beliefs have proved themselves to have the plausibility that allows us to privilege them.

A second objection to foundationalism is the meta-justification argument. The idea is that basic beliefs cannot resolve the DIJ because, even if their justification does not depend on other beliefs, it does depend on reasons which themselves require reasons. If I believe a proposition because it is indubitable, then I must have some reason for thinking that indubitable beliefs are likely to be true. If I do not, I am stuck with Horn A, and if I do, I am stuck with Horn B. To demonstrate this problem, Peter Klein (2005) asks us to imagine an argument between Fred and Doris, where Fred has come to what he regards as the basic belief on which his argument depends; call it b.

According to Fred, b has autonomous justification, that is, is a type of basic belief. Doris happens to agree that b is autonomously justified but asks whether beliefs with autonomous warrant are likely to be true. As a foundationalist, the most plausible option for Fred is the following: “He can hold that autonomously warranted propositions are somewhat likely to be true in virtue of the fact that they are autonomously warranted” (2005: 133).

If Fred is right, however, b only works as a justification for the rest of his argument precisely because he has added something to b. What has he added? Namely, that he “has a very good reason for believing b, namely b has F and propositions with F are likely to be true.” These are propositions independent of b that serve to justify b. Klein continues: “Of course Fred, now, could be asked to produce his reasons for thinking that b has F and that basic propositions are somewhat likely to be true in virtue of possessing feature F” (2005: 134). If this is right, basic beliefs do not stop the regress of reasons (see also Smithies 2014).

One response to this criticism comes from Laurence BonJour, who argues that it is plausible to think that understanding b includes a sort of built-in awareness of the content of those additional premises Klein mentions, such that understanding b constitutes, in and of itself, a reason to hold b (BonJour and Sosa 2003: 60-68). If it is possible to have an evidential state that includes, non-inferentially, all the content necessary for having a reason to believe a proposition is true, foundationalists may be able to describe a basic belief that stops the regress and avoids skepticism. But explaining just what this state is remains a point of controversy.

Another response is to construct an inference to the best explanation, as mentioned above in response to the self-defeat objection (Elgin, 2005; Conee and Feldman, 2008). The result, again, is typically a hybrid view, which may be equivalent to giving up foundationalism. Conee and Feldman say their view is closer to a “non-traditional version of coherentism” (2008: 98). And Elgin calls her view “a very weak foundationalism or…a coherence theory” (2005: 166). This raises questions about the merits of coherentism, to which we now turn.

3. Internalist Coherentism

Like foundationalists, coherentists attempt to avoid skepticism while rejecting infinitism. But they find a further problem with foundationalism. Every sensory state (seeing red, smelling cinnamon, and so forth) must be understood in a mental context, that is, one must have a set of background experiences, beliefs, and vocabulary sufficiently large for forming and understanding beliefs. All sensory beliefs, such as “I see red” and “I smell cinnamon,” require an immensely complex set of assumptions about self-reference, seeing, colors, smelling, and scents. This means that individual beliefs are not isolated bits of information that act as bricks in a building; they are nodes of information that depend for their meaning and support on a web of relationships with other beliefs.

Many coherentists accept the inferential assumption and argue that the result is not an infinite regress of inferences, but a non-linear system of support from which justification emerges as a property of the combination of inferences. As Donald Davidson puts it, “[N]othing can count as a reason for holding a belief except another belief” (2000: 156). Other coherentists reject the inferential assumption and argue that the result is a non-linear system of support from which justification emerges as a property of the set as a whole. Keith Lehrer explains: “This does not make the belief self-justified, however, even though it might be non-inferential. The belief is not justified independently of relations to other beliefs. It is justified because of the way it coheres with other beliefs belonging to a system of beliefs” (1990: 89). As we see below (§3.b), some coherentists reject the belief requirement of the inferential assumption, arguing that perceptual experiences can play a justifying role in the set of mental states that includes a person’s beliefs.

Regardless of whether coherentists accept the inferential assumption, they can allow that some beliefs are non-inferentially generated—for example, by experiences, intuitions, hunches, and so forth. But they are committed to the idea that the justification for beliefs generated in these ways depends essentially on their relationship to the person’s complete set of beliefs. Construed in this way, coherentism is specifically a view about justification and should not be confused with coherentism about a truth. Some philosophers have held both coherentism about truth and justification (Blanshard 1939 and Lewis 1946), but many who hold coherentism about justification reject coherentism about truth (see BonJour 1985, ch. 5, and Truth).

a. Varieties of Coherence

Broadly, coherentists argue that a belief is justified just in case it stands in a system of mutually supporting relationships with other beliefs in a person’s system of beliefs. For instance, my belief that the cat is on the mat involves a complicated set of beliefs: I am seeing a cat, I am seeing a mat, I am seeing a cat on a mat, a cat is a particular kind of mammal, a mat is a particular type of floor covering, my vision is generally reliable under normal circumstances, these are normal circumstances, and so forth. It is difficult to imagine arranging these in a linear, foundationalist fashion. In addition, it is not clear whether some of these beliefs are more basic than some others. Nevertheless, they all cohere, which means they are logically consistent with one another and with other beliefs in my belief set, and they mutually support one another. The challenge for coherentists is to explain just what “mutual support” amounts to.

Whereas foundationalists employ the metaphor of a building (or a pyramid, in some cases) to explain justificational relationships, coherentists employ the metaphor of a web (or, in some cases, a raft), according to which, each node (or plank) works alongside the others in a non-linear fashion to constitute a stable, interconnected whole (see Figure 2, as well as Neurath 1932, Quine 1970, and Sosa 1980). There are four candidates for how the web or raft holds together: logical consistency, logical entailment, inductive probability, and explanation.

      Figure 2: Simple Coherentist Justification

                P-S represent propositions;

         the arrows represent lines of inference.

The first candidate, logical consistency, is generally regarded as necessary for coherence but too weak to stand on its own. For example, the belief that P and the belief that probably not-P are logically consistent. But they are not coherent; if one of them is true, the other is not likely to be true (BonJour 1985, ch. 5). Therefore, some early coherentists added that the relationship must also include logical entailment. This view, which I will call entailment coherentism, has it that a belief is justified just in case it entails or is entailed by every other belief in a person’s belief set (Blanshard 1939). Most coherentists now reject this relationship as overly strict, primarily because it seems possible to have two very different beliefs, neither of which entails the other and yet which are both justified. For example, consider the beliefs “I am seeing a needle puncture my skin” and “I am feeling pain.” Neither belief entails the other; nevertheless, it is intuitively plausible that both belong to a coherent set of beliefs.

Because of the problems with mere consistency and consistency plus entailment, most coherentists allow that entailment is sufficient for coherence but not necessary. To capture weaker relationships, they expand the notion to include inductive probability. Inductive probability coherentism is the view that a belief is justified just in case it is a member of a set each of whose members is entailed by or made more probable by a subset of the rest. C. I. Lewis, calling this type of justification “congruence,” puts it eloquently: “A set of statements, or a set of supposed facts asserted, will be said to be congruent if and only if they are so related that the antecedent probability of any one of them will be increased if the remainder of the set can be assumed as given premises” (1962). With their emphasis on inferential relations among beliefs, entailment and inductive probability coherentism attempt to resolve the DIJ by capturing the intuitive plausibility of the inferential assumption while avoiding the difficulties with basic beliefs.

Unfortunately, inductive probability coherentism faces problems similar to those that face entailment coherentism. It seems plausible for a person to hold two justified beliefs without the antecedent probability of either increasing the epistemic probability of the other, even when conjoined with other beliefs in the set. Consider, for example, your beliefs that “the Red Sox will win the Pennant” and “John F. Kennedy was shot in 1963.” Both beliefs are reasonably part of a person’s belief system, and yet it is difficult to see how one might contribute to a set of beliefs that makes the other more probable. Second, even if a subset of beliefs in a set increase the probability of each other member, the set might not be sufficiently comprehensive or well-connected with one’s experiences to justify one’s beliefs. Imagine a set of 100 beliefs, any 99 of which render the 100^th member more probable than its antecedent probability. This set passes the inductive probability test and is, therefore, coherent on this account, but it includes very few beliefs. This suggests that, in order to maintain coherence, we could arbitrarily expand or contract our set of beliefs at will to avoid loss of rationality. The only guideline is that we preserve strong inductive inferences. Unfortunately, such arbitrary sets ignore important differences in the sources of beliefs; we can imagine two inductively coherent sets, one that includes sensory beliefs and one that does not. Inductive probability coherentism, without further qualification, implies that neither set is more rational than the other. As Catherine Z. Elgin puts it, “A good nineteenth-century novel is highly coherent, but not credible on that account. Even though Middlemarch is far more coherent than our regrettably fragmentary and disjointed views…, the best explanation of its coherence lies in the novelist’s craft, not in the truth…of the story” (2005: 159-60).

A third prominent account of coherence aimed at avoiding this criticism allows that entailment and inductive probability can contribute to coherence but only insofar as they function in a plausible explanation of the set of beliefs. According to this view, known as explanatory coherentism, beliefs are justified just in case they explain or are explained by the other beliefs of the same type (Harman 1986 and Poston 2014). This view is not committed to the inferential assumption and argues that justification is an emergent property of the explanatory relations among beliefs. Catherine Z. Elgin says that “epistemic justification is primarily a property of a suitably comprehensive, coherent account, when the best explanation of coherence is that the account is at least roughly true” (2005: 158). Elgin adds that the beliefs comprising a coherent system “must be mutually consistent, cotenable, and supportive. That is, the components must be reasonable in light of one another” (2005: 158).

Explanatory coherentism takes its motivation from responses to a problem in philosophy of science that was similar to the problem that faces inductive probability coherentism (Neurath 1932 and Hempel 1935). Not every proposition in a scientific theory is derived inferentially from others, and so there is some question as to whether such propositions could be believed justifiably. It turns out, though, that those propositions play an important explanatory role in the theory that organizes evidence and concepts in plausible ways, even if those propositions have no antecedent probability outside of the system. Elgin explains, “For example, although there is no direct evidence of positrons, symmetry considerations show that a physical theory that eschewed them would be significantly less coherent than one that acknowledged them. So physicists’ commitment to positrons is epistemically appropriate” (2005: 164). This suggests that explanations can play a justifying role independently of inferential relations, thus lending plausibility to coherentism.

Explanatory coherence avoids criticisms of earlier accounts in that it (1) maintains that consistency is an important constraint on a belief set, and (2) maintains that inferential relations contribute to explanatory power, while (3) also accounting for the intuitive connection of certain beliefs with sensory evidence and non-inferential coherence relations. Nevertheless, some criticisms have led philosophers like BonJour (1985), Lehrer (1974; 1990), and Poston (2014) to add other interesting and influential conditions to coherence theories, though space prevents us from exploring them here.

b. Objections to Coherentism

There are three prominent objections to coherentism. The first, which we already encountered in §2.b, is called the circularity problem. Since coherentism depends on mutual support relations, every particular belief will likely play an essential role in its own justification, rendering coherentist justification a form of circular argument (see Figure 3).

The problem with circular justification is that it putatively undermines the goal of justification, which is to garner support for claim. If a claim is inferred from itself (P à P), the concluding proposition has only as much support as the premise, but that is precisely what we do not know. Therefore, multiplying the inferences between a proposition and an inference to that proposition (for example, (P à Q); (Q à R); (R à S); (S à P)) cannot justify P.

In response, some coherentists argue that the circularity objection oversimplifies the view. While it is true that a belief will almost certainly play a role in its own justification, this is only problematic if we assume the justificational relationship is linear. Properly understood, justification is a property that emerges from non-linear relationships among beliefs, whether inferential or non-inferential. For example, Catharine Z. Elgin tells a story about Meg (adapted from a story by Lewis 1946), whose logic textbook was stolen. There were three witnesses to the theft, but all are unreliable witnesses (one is aloof, one has severe vision problems, and one is a known liar). Nevertheless, all three witnesses agree that the thief had spiked green hair. Despite the fact that no one of the witnesses is reliable, their independent testimony to a single, unique proposition increases the likelihood that the proposition is true. As Elgin puts it, “This [agreement] makes a difference. … Their accord evidently enhances the epistemic standing of the individual reports” (2005: 157). If this is right, the antecedently low probability of the thief’s having spiked green hair can be added to the combined strength of the testimonies to create a justified belief without vicious circularity.

A second objection to coherentism is called the isolation objection. Even if a collection of beliefs could explain, and thereby justify, its members, it is not obvious how this set of beliefs is connected with reality, that is, with the content the beliefs are about. In rejecting basic beliefs, coherentists reject privileging any particular cognitive state in the belief system, such as sensory experiences. All beliefs are treated equally and are evaluated according to whether they cohere with the belief set. But beliefs can cohere with one another regardless of whether their content expresses true propositions about reality. Coherence cannot guarantee that the set is not isolated from reality.

Some coherentists respond to this objection by making special provisions for beliefs that derive from coherence-increasing sources, such as sense experience. (BonJour (1985) calls such beliefs “cognitively spontaneous beliefs.”) This makes the degree of coherence partly a matter of how well the system of beliefs integrates sense perception. Others appeal to more abstract distinctions among types of justification. For example, Keith Lehrer (1986) distinguishes personal justification, which involves the traditional, internalist coherence requirement, from verific justification, which is an externalist requirement on coherence. While objective coherence may be outside a person’s ken, it nevertheless contributes, along with personal justification, to what Lehrer calls complete justification. This externalist requirement helps to ground a person’s system of beliefs in the world those beliefs are supposed to be about.

Another coherentist response to the isolation objection is to allow experience itself, not just beliefs about experience, to figure in the evaluation of coherence. Catherine Z. Elgin (2005) argues that we have good reasons to privilege some perceptual experiences over very coherent sets of beliefs. She argues that this is because perception does not—contra foundationalists—work in isolation from other sorts of evidence. She says, “Only observations we have reason to trust have the power to unseat theories. So it is not an observation in isolation, but an observation backed by reasons that actually discredits the theory” (162). This also explains how we are able to privilege some perceptual experiences over others (say, in unfavorable conditions), though she admits that her view includes “something other than coherence,” and allows that it is a very weak form of foundationalism. For a reply along these lines that maintains a more traditional version of coherentism, see Kvanvig and Riggs (1992).

A third objection is called the plurality objection. Because justification is determined solely by the internal coherence of a person’s beliefs, coherence theory cannot guarantee that there is “one uniquely justified system of beliefs” (BonJour 1985: 107). BonJour explains that this is because “on any plausible conception of coherence, there will always be many, probably infinitely many, different and incompatible systems of belief which are equally coherent” (ibid.). To show just how pernicious this problem is, Lehrer asks us to imagine one set of beliefs comprised of both necessary and contingent beliefs and then to imagine a second set created by negating all the contingent beliefs in the first set (1990: 90). This has the nasty implication that, if coherence is sufficient for justification, then “for any contingent statement a person is completely justified in accepting is such that he is also completely justified in accepting the denial of that statement” (ibid.).

One response to the plurality objection is to invoke a “total evidence” requirement on explanatory and probabilistic relations. While we can arbitrarily construct probabilistically and explanatorily coherent sets, there is a non-trivial sense in which non-belief states explain our beliefs: sensation, testimony, and so forth. A theory of explanation that includes the antecedent probabilities of the beliefs based on this evidence would be more coherent with our total evidence than an arbitrary set of beliefs that ignores them. Recent debates over the relationship between coherence and truth include sophisticated analyses of probabilistic assessments (Klein and Warfield 1994 and Fitelson 2003) and an interesting argument for the impossibility of coherence’s increasing the probability that a belief is true (Olsson 2009), but there is not space to develop these arguments here.

For more on coherentism, see Coherentism in Epistemology.

4. Infinitism

Infinitism is an internalist view that proposes to resolve the dilemma of inferential justification by showing that Horn B of the DIJ, properly construed, is an acceptable option. In fact, argue infinitists, there are no serious problems with an infinite chain of justifying beliefs.

Traditionally, epistemologists have rejected the idea that a belief’s linear chain of justifying beliefs can extend infinitely because it leaves all beliefs ultimately unjustified. Inferential justification is said to transmit justification, not create it; therefore, an infinite chain of justifying beliefs would have no source of support to transmit. Similarly, since one could not hold an infinite number of beliefs or mentally trace an infinitely long chain of beliefs, infinitism betrays a common internalist intuition that a person must be aware of good reasons for holding a belief.

Infinitists claim these criticisms are misguided. In practice, justification is not as tidy as epistemologists would have us believe. The traditional idea that the regress must stop or bottom out in basic beliefs is unrealistic and unnecessary. Few of us attempt to draw inferences long enough to arrive at basic beliefs. We often stop looking for reasons when we are content that we have fulfilled our epistemic responsibility, not because the chain has actually ended (Aikin 2011). Foundationalists and coherentists, then, are relatively unconcerned with ultimate justification in their own epistemic behavior and, therefore, to hold epistemic justification to such high standards renders very few of our beliefs justified. To accommodate this messiness, infinitists might reject the inferential assumption, at least as classically understood. Like coherentists, infinitists may hold that justification is an emergent property of a set of beliefs and that justification comes in degrees such that, the longer the inferential chain, the stronger the degree of justification (Klein 2005).

a. Arguments for Infinitism

There are two main lines of argument for infinitism. The first is that foundationalism and coherentism cannot stop the structure of justification from regressing infinitely. For example, Peter Klein (2005) constructs a version of the meta-justification argument against foundationalism and argues that the most plausible version of coherentism (emergent justification accounts), because of its appeal to a basic assumption about the reliability of coherent sets, is merely a disguised form of foundationalism. If these arguments hit their mark, and if externalism is ruled out, infinitism may be the only non-skeptical option available.

The second main line of argument for infinitism is that the classic objections to infinitism are aimed at overly simplistic versions of the view; they do not threaten suitably qualified versions. For example, Scott Aikin (2009) argues that concerns about the regress arise because of a conflict between two types of intuition: (1) proceduralism, which includes our standard intuitions about good reasons and responsible believing, and (2) egalitarianism, which includes our intuitions that people are generally justified in believing a lot of things (beliefs about how to set DVRs and beliefs about how to get from home to work). Aikin claims that infinitists take the demands of proceduralism more seriously than egalitarian intuitions, maintaining that justification and knowledge are very difficult to attain. The more committed we are to following our chains of evidence, the more likely we are to attain our epistemic goals. However, we often stop far from what even foundationalists would take to be the end of those chains. And at every proposed stopping point, there is an infinite number of justificational questions about the appropriateness of the terms we are using, the reliability of our perceptions and concept attributions, and so forth. If this is right, infinitism may be the most plausible implication of our epistemic intuitions.

Similarly, Peter Klein (2014) argues that infinitism is a minimal thesis about what makes justification valuable, namely, that it renders our beliefs “reason-enhanced.” He says, “Infinitism holds that a belief-state is reason-enhanced whenever S deploys a reason for believing that p. Importantly, S can make a belief-state reason-enhanced even if the basis is another belief-state that is not (yet) reason-enhanced” (2014: 105). If this is right, then the process of inferring can create or produce original epistemic support, and we need not appeal to anything like basic beliefs for ultimate support. Further, infinitists do not object to a chain of inference’s stopping, for instance, when some presuppositions are explicit. For example, reasoning about Euclidean geometry may appropriately stop at Euclid’s axioms when we agree that they are our standard of evaluation. But we can also admit that those axioms can be challenged, and our reasoning could continue indefinitely. Infinitists simply argue that this is a standard feature of all justification.

b. Objections to Qualified Infinitism

Carl Ginet (2005) argues that even qualified infinitism is motivated on spurious grounds. One argument against foundationalism is that, even for basic beliefs, one needs a reason to believe they are true, and this initiates an infinite regress of reasons. Ginet objects, however, that this argument threatens foundationalism only if all reasons are inferential reasons. Of course, this is precisely what foundationalists reject. If some non-belief reasons are justified independently of any additional reasons for thinking they are true, that is, if they are inherently reasonable, the infinitist argument against foundationalism is question-begging.

In response, the infinitist might contend that, even if its critique of foundationalism is flawed, infinitism may yet be the more plausible alternative. If infinitism captures our intuitions about justification as adequately as foundationalism, and if it requires fewer controversial concepts (basic beliefs), infinitism may be an attractive competitor.

Another objection to infinitism is that, given our finite minds, we lack complete access to the infinite set of justifying beliefs. If a person has no access to his reason for belief, then infinitism is no longer internalist and, thereby, loses its means of defusing the DIJ. Of course, the infinitist may concede this and fall back on a mentalist account of epistemic access (see §5.a below). As Ginet puts it: a belief (L) “is available to S as a reason for so believing only if S is disposed, upon entertaining and accepting (L), to believe that the fact that (L) was among his reasons for so believing” (2005: 146). If this is right, a person may have a disposition to recognize further evidence for his justifying beliefs when prompted to do so.

Nevertheless, even this mentalist-enhanced infinitism faces the concern that the process of justification is never complete. An assumption behind the DIJ is that, if for any belief, there is not a reason to believe it is true, that belief and any beliefs inferred from it are unjustified. If this is right, and the justification condition for infinitism is never actually met, then we are left with skepticism.

A variation on this criticism is the idea that inferential justification can only transmit justification and cannot originate it. The idea is that all inference is conditional ((P → Q); (Q → R); (R → S)). Given this set of propositions, is S justified for us? That depends on whether P is justified. Telling us that P is justified by N, (N → P), though, does not answer the question of whether S is justified. We still need to know whether N is justified (Dancy 1985: 55). If this is right, then no matter how long the chain of inference is—even if it is infinite—no belief is justified.

Infinitists may respond to this objection by arguing that the justification condition is not a matter of getting to a final, infinitely large set, but of increasing one’s epistemic reasons for the proposition in question. Peter Klein, using the term “warrant” for “justification,” says that infinitism is like coherentism in this respect. He says, “Infinitism is like the warrant-emergent form of coherentism because it holds that warrant for a questioned proposition emerges as the proposition becomes embedded in a set of propositions” (2005: 135). Further, Klein explains that “warrant increases not because we are getting closer to a basic proposition but rather because we are getting further from the questioned proposition” (137). This amounts to a rejection of the claim that inferential justification can only transmit justification and, therefore, that a justificational chain must be complete in order to be adequate (recall Catherine Z. Elgin’s story about Meg in §3.b above).

A worry for this response is similar to a worry for coherentism. Any criterion that implies the infinite set of beliefs is justified is either part of the set or independent of it, in which case, it, too, needs a justification. If some sort of justification-conferring awareness is built into the increasingly large set, infinitism seems like foundationalism in disguise.

A further worry is that, if infinitists do not require that a person actually have an infinite number of justifying beliefs or perform an infinite number of inferences, then infinitism seems committed to the idea that inference itself can create justification. This, however, seems implausible. Carl Ginet writes, “…acceptable inference preserves justification … [but] there is nothing in the inferential relation itself that contributes to making any of those beliefs justified” (2005: 148-49). If inference cannot produce justification, it is unclear how a belief in an infinite chain of inferences comes to be justified.

For a more detailed treatment of infinitism, see Infinitism in Epistemology.

5. Types of Internalism and Objections

As noted above (§2), the view that justification is something we can determine by directly consulting our mental states is called internalism. This view does not entail that all epistemic concepts are internal. John Greco gives an example to demonstrate the difference: “[S]uppose that someone learns the history of his country from unreliable testimony. Although the person has every reason to believe the books that he reads and the people that teach him, his understanding of history is in fact the result of systematic lies and other sorts of deception” (2005: 259). Objectively speaking, this person’s beliefs are not reliably connected with reality. Subjectively, though, he is following his evidence to their rational conclusion. Should we say this person’s beliefs are justified? Since the reliability of his sources is beyond his ability to evaluate, the internalist says he has fulfilled his epistemic duty: yes, he is justified.

For centuries, there was no serious alternative to internalism. As we will see in §6, the advent of the Gettier case in the 20^th century constitutes a serious challenge to internalism, and it contributed to alternative, externalist accounts of knowledge and justification. This move to externalism also led to closer scrutiny of internalism, and new concerns about its adequacy arose. I review just two of these here. But before doing so, it is helpful to distinguish two types of internalism: accessibilism and mentalism.

a. Accessibilism and Mentalism

According to accessibilists, in order for a belief to be justified for a person, that person must have “reflective access” to good reasons for holding that belief. To have reflective access is to be directly mentally aware of reasons for holding a belief. Some accessibilists argue that a person’s access must be occurrent, that is, she must be currently aware of her reasons for holding a belief (Conee and Feldman 2004). Others hold the looser requirement that, as long as a person has had direct access to relevant justifying reason, she is justified in holding the supported belief.

According to mentalists, reflective access may be sufficient for justification, but it is not necessary. All that is necessary for a belief to be justified is that a person has mental states that justify the belief, regardless of whether a person has reflective access to those states. Mentalists allow that some non-reflectively accessible mental states can justify beliefs.

Mentalism is supposed to have several advantages over accessibilism given the standard criticisms of internalism. For example, some have objected to internalism on the grounds that it cannot accommodate intuitive cases of stored or forgotten evidence. If, for example, you are driving and not thinking about whether Washington, D.C. is the capital of the United States, or you have forgotten any evidence for this belief, are you justified in believing that it is? If not, could we say that you know it is the capital? Accessibilists claim that a person must be able to access her evidence for a belief while she is currently thinking about it and presumably without prompting. Few of us, though, hold (or even could hold) a belief with all its attendant reasons in mind at once. Similarly, it seems reasonable to imagine that a person is justified in believing a proposition for which she has forgotten her evidence. Mentalists can handle these cases by claiming that the ability to access stored facts can constitute dispositional justification, and that even in cases of forgotten evidence, it could still be the case that the fact that it is justified is consciously available, either occurrently or dispositionally (Conee and Feldman 2004).

The worry for mentalism is that, in allowing non-occurrent mental states to count as reasons, mentalism betrays its claim to be internalist. For example, there may be a lot of evidence I could have that P is true if I were in the right place at the right time. But the existence of that evidence does not obviously justify P for me since being in such a place might be a matter of luck. Being at the right place at the right time may mean that the evidence that, say, “Washington is the capital,” is in a book nearby that I never happen to read or that the evidence is one of my mental states that I am not currently thinking about, even if I could when prompted. Specifying just what it means for evidence to be available but not occurrent turns out to be quite difficult. Richard Feldman (1988) argues that in neither of these examples am I justified in believing that Washington is the capital and that a mental state counts as evidence if and only if one is currently thinking of P. Feldman embraces the counterintuitive implication that “one does not know things such as that Washington is the capital when one is not thinking of them” (237). Despite these difficulties, the distinction between accessibilism and mentalism plays an important role in the debate over internalism.

For more on accessibilism and mentalism, see §1.c of, Internalism and Externalism in Epistemology.

b. Objections to Internalism

In addition to the Gettier problem (§6), there many other lines of argument that challenge internalism. Here, I review only three. One of these lines is called the access problem. Traditional foundationalists have accepted some version of accessibilism. For example, Roderick Chisholm writes that justification is “internal and immediate in that one can find out directly, by reflection, what one is justified in believing at any time” (1989: 7). But what if the belief P that justifies my current belief Q is tucked far back in the recesses of my memory and would require more time than I currently have to access it? Am I still justified in believing Q? Or worse, imagine that I have forgotten P; there is no possibility that I can directly access it. However, Q seems true to me, I remember that I had good reasons for believing it, and I do not have any reasons to doubt Q now. Am I justified in believing Q in this case?

Without some modification, the internalist must say no in both cases—the relevant evidence is neither immediately nor reflectively available—though intuitively these are normal cases of justified belief. The standard response is two-fold. First, we must admit that justification comes in degrees: having more evidence can increase one’s justification and some evidence is stronger than others. And second, the state of seeming to be justified or remembering that I am justified can, themselves, constitute reasons for belief. Therefore, in these cases, the internalist might respond that, while the justifications are not as strong as we would prefer, they are, nonetheless, based on accessible mental states.

A second, related objection to internalism is what, following John Greco, I will call the etiology problem. Internalism tends to make justification so easy that it is unclear how one is able to distinguish between good and bad reasons. Consider an example from Greco (2005):

Charlie is a wishful thinker and believes that he is about to arrive at his destination on time. He has good reasons for believing this, including his memory of train schedules, maps, the correct time at departure and at various stops, etc. However, none of these things is behind his belief—he does not believe what he does because he has these reasons. Rather, it is his wishful thinking that causes his belief. Accordingly, he would believe that he is about arrive on time even if he were not. (261)

Why is the combination of his beliefs about schedules, maps, and time a better reason for thinking he is about to arrive than wishful thinking? Presumably, it is because those things are reliable indicators of truth, whereas wishful thinking is not. Being a reliable indicator of truth, though, is an external relationship between the belief and the world—something to which Charlie has no access. We can arrive at a similar result from imagining that Charlie does base his beliefs on his beliefs about train schedules, and so forth, but stipulating that he formed those beliefs carelessly and haphazardly, and only accidentally arrived at the correct conclusion. Nevertheless, based on these beliefs, it seems clear to Charlie that the conclusion follows.

An internalist might respond that this objection depends on the mistaken assumption that internal factors exclude empirical evidence. To see how this assumption slips in, consider how an externalist might determine that train schedules are more fitting sources of evidence than wishful thinking. Presumably, externalists would evaluate the past track record of each source of evidence to see which more reliably indicates truth. The act of “reviewing their past track records,” however, involves appealing to internal states about what seems to be their track records and, therefore, is not obviously different from what an internalist would do; one has internal access to evidence that train arrivals correspond more reliably with train schedules than with wishes. By demanding that justification depends only on external features of the belief-forming process, and then appealing to internal features to evaluate external reliability, Greco is not denying that one must have good, accessible reasons for her beliefs; he is simply disguising the internal features by including them in the external conditions (Feldman 2005: 281). Therefore, either objective etiology is essential to justification, and, therefore, since no one has access to it, we are left with skepticism, or subjective access to evidence of reliable etiology is sufficient for justification, and the externalist criticism misses its mark.

Both the access problem and the etiology problem challenge the idea that we can determine whether we are justified by appeal to internal states. But even if this challenge can be answered, internalism is sometimes thought to imply that we can voluntarily control or change what we believe, that is, that we are guided but not determined by our evidence. The view that we have voluntary control over what we believe is called doxastic voluntarism (from the Greek doxa, for “what is given” and sometimes for “what is believed”). The idea is that internalism is intuitive partially because it allows us to take responsibility for our epistemic behavior. In fact, “[n]onvoluntarism is generally taken to rule out responsibility, since one is not responsible for what one does not control” (Adler 2002: 64). Taking responsibility implies we can decide to respond to evidence well or poorly. This suggests a third objection to internalism called the guidance problem. (For presentations of the guidance problem, see John Heil 1983 and William Alston 1989.)

It turns out that it is difficult to control what we believe: try to make yourself believe you are not reading this page or that you are not real. It is unclear what it would take to convince you that such things are true. That kind of shift would seem to require a complete change in your evidence. But if that is right, then our beliefs are tied strongly to factors outside our control; we cannot simply decide what evidence we have or whether to believe on the basis of that evidence. According to this critique, the idea that internalism explains how we take responsibility for our beliefs is misguided.

In response, contemporary internalists tend to accept that our beliefs are largely determined by the evidence we perceive ourselves to have, but they reject the idea that complete or even partial voluntary control is necessary for responsibility. Carl Ginet (2001) argues that our control over our beliefs is limited but that we nonetheless may decide what to believe in those cases where the evidence is indecisive, cases “where the subject has it open to her also to not come to believe it” (74). Further, Earl Conee and Richard Feldman (2004) argue that a person’s beliefs may appropriately fit one’s evidence even if she cannot control whether she forms those beliefs. For instance:

Suppose that a person spontaneously and involuntarily believes that the lights are on in the room, as a result of the familiar sort of completely convincing perceptual evidence. This belief is clearly justified, whether or not the person cannot voluntarily acquire, lose, or modify the cognitive process that led to the belief. (85)

For a more comprehensive treatment of the debate between internalists and externalists, see Internalism and Externalism in Epistemology.

6. The Gettier Era

The idea that justification is the crucial link between true belief and knowledge seems to be implicit in epistemology since Plato. In Theatetus, Socrates gives an example of a jury that has been persuaded by hearsay of a true judgment that can only be known by an eye-witness (201b-c). This example shows that “true judgment” is not the same thing as “knowledge,” and, therefore, that some other element is needed. Theatetus suggests that knowledge is true judgment plus a logos—an account or argument. Socrates considers three ways of giving an account of a true judgment but concludes that none is plausible. Nevertheless, from then until now, philosophers have generally thought something like the Theatetus’s suggestion must be right, and most of those accounts have been internalist. Socrates’s own suggestion, in Plato’s Meno, is that knowledge is a type of remembrance of what is true based on direct experience prior to being born. Descartes tries to close the gap between true belief and knowledge with the apprehension of clarity and distinctness. Kant attempts to bring them together with the transcendental apperception of the conditions for the possibility of veridical perception. In each case, the knower is assumed to have direct access to something that explains when true belief is knowledge.

Unfortunately, a thought experiment developed in the 20^th century challenges the idea that any internal criteria can distinguish knowledge from accidentally true belief. This thought experiment was named the Gettier Problem after Edmund Gettier, who introduced the most influential examples in a famously brief 1963 paper. Examples from other philosophers proliferated after Gettier’s publication, but each new instance is standardly called a “Gettier Case.”

a. The History of the Gettier Problem

The idea is that there are cases where all three conditions on knowledge are met—a belief is justified and true—and yet that belief fails to be knowledge. Although some traditional internalists have allowed that a false belief can be justified, they have resisted the idea that a belief’s justification does not contribute to the likelihood of knowing. But if Gettier cases are successful, it is possible to be justified (in the classic internalist sense) in holding a true belief without that belief’s being knowledge.

The the broken clock example in §1 is an early version of this problem, constructed by Bertrand Russell (1948). Here is another example Russell includes alongside his clock case:

There is the man who believes, truly, that the last name of the Prime Minister in 1906 began with a B, but believes this because he believes that Balfour was Prime Minister then, whereas in fact it was Campbell-Bannerman. … Such instances can be multiplied indefinitely, and show that you cannot claim to have known merely because you turned out to be right. (171)

The problem, though, contra Russell, is not merely that such a person turns out to be right; it is that the person’s belief is justified in cases where a belief turns out to be true by luck; justified true belief in these cases does not increase the likelihood that the belief is knowledge. The evidence that justifies the belief is not connected with the truth of the belief in the right way, and, recall from the introduction, believing in the right way is precisely the sort of thing justification is supposed to indicate.

Such cases trace at least as far back as Alexius Meinong (1906), but the most famous are Gettier’s. His cases are interesting because they show that such cases can occur even when our evidence includes logical entailment. In his first example, Gettier asks us to imagine that two men, Smith and Jones, have applied for the same job. Imagine also that Smith has very good reasons for believing: “Jones will get the job” and “Jones has 10 coins in his pocket.” From this, it follows logically that: “The man who will get the job has 10 coins in his pocket,” and Smith forms the belief that this is true. As it turns out, however, Smith has 10 coins in his pocket (though he does not know it) and he will get the job. So, Smith’s belief that the man who will get the job has 10 coins in his pocket is true, and he has good reasons for why this is so, but his reasons are unconnected with the real reasons it is true. Most philosophers have concluded that, since Smith’s true belief is just a matter of luck (and not a function of his reasons’ connection with the state of affairs that make it true), Smith does not know that the man who will get the job has 10 coins in his pocket.

Because of the many possible variations on cases like these, the idea that justification is based on evidence to which we have direct access faces a serious challenge. There is no clear sense in which that sort of evidence always or even regularly increases the likelihood that a belief is knowledge.

b. Responses to the Gettier Problem

Some philosophers have tried to save strong internalist justification from Gettier cases. For example, D. M. Armstrong—although he ultimately defends an externalist theory of justification—argues that Gettier cases can be avoided by adding a requirement that all evidence for a belief must be, not merely justified, but also knowledge. In the Gettier case above, since it is false that Jones will get the job, this belief cannot be knowledge for Smith and, therefore, undermines Smith’s ability to know the man who will get the job has 10 coins in his pocket. (See Feldman 1974 for a counterexample.)

Others weaken the requirements on justification by arguing that, while knowledge may have constraints outside our conscious access, justification is more plausibly about responsible or apt belief than truth. Call this weak internalist justification (see Zagzebski, 1996).

Still others argue that Gettier cases suggest either that justification is simply not an internal matter or that knowledge does not require justification. Those who argue that justification is external claim that whether a belief is justified depends on whether there is a law-like connection (conceptual or physical) between a belief and the state of affairs it is about (Bergmann 2006). This approach is externalist because it explains justification in terms of belief-forming processes outside the mental life of the believer. In adopting externalism, some treat internal mental states as irrelevant for justification, while others argue that internal states can play an indirect and partial role in justification. Ernest Sosa (1991), for example, argues that internal states can contribute to the state of affairs that grounds the reliability of certain belief-forming behaviors.

7. Externalist Foundationalism

Gettier cases, in addition to other challenges to internalism, have led some epistemologists to reject the idea that justification requires an internal condition. In its most minimal form, externalism is the view that internalism is false, that is, that some features external to the mental life of a person play a necessary role in justification (Greco 2005: 258). However, many versions of externalism also explicitly reject internal conditions for justification, at least for non-inferential knowledge. Some philosophers have developed externalist accounts of knowledge that lack any account of justification (compare, Goldman, 1967, though he has since given up this view). The debate between externalists and internalists, though, is primarily about justification. Externalist accounts of justification differ from internalist accounts by challenging the idea that justification is primarily or ultimately about good reasons when good reasons are construed as mental states.

To accommodate the external features that connect beliefs with states of the world, externalists modify what was traditionally meant by justification; rather than appealing to a person’s subjective perspective on her evidence, externalists appeal to the objective features of the belief-forming and -holding behavior. Epistemic standing is not about the reasons a person has; it is about the relationship between a belief and the world, how that belief is formed or how it is maintained, and where the relationship is not a guarantee of truth but a strong indicator of truth, typically because of a causal, lawful, conceptual, or counterfactual connection with the states of affairs the belief is about. The most prominent version of externalism is the view that a belief is justified just in case it is caused by a reliable process, where “reliable” means that the process produces more true beliefs than false.

a. Externalism, Foundationalism, and the DIJ

Externalists agree that, to resolve the DIJ, one needs to avoid infinite regress and skepticism. So, rather than grounding justification in other beliefs (as coherentists do) or in non-belief states (as classical foundationalists do), externalists ground justification and knowledge in the objective way the world contributes to belief formation or maintenance.

Some externalists, like Armstrong (1973) and Goldman (1979), make room for something like basic beliefs, from which something like non-basic beliefs are inferred. This means that contemporary externalists tend to accept the foundationalist structure—some beliefs are produced reliably by non-belief states, and some beliefs can be produced by other beliefs—though they reject the distinction between basic and non-basic beliefs. All belief-forming processes are states external to the knower’s mental states, and whether a belief is justified (and, therefore, knowledge) depends on the reliability of those processes.

Unlike classical foundationalists, who appeal to internal seemings, indubitability, or self-evidence as justifying these states, externalists like Goldman argue that these states are knowledge simply because they stand in a reliable relationship with the world. A non-inferential belief is knowledge when and because it is lawfully (Armstrong) or reliably (Goldman) produced.

b. Reliabilism

The concept of reliability is crucial to externalist theories of justification (in contrast to externalist theories of knowledge, for example, Goldman 1967, 1976 and Armstrong 1973). There are two types of reliabilist theories of justification. According to reliable indicator theories, a belief is justified just in case its reason or ground is a reliable indicator of the belief’s truth (Swain 1981 and Alston 1988). According to process reliabilism, a belief is justified just in case it was causally produced by reliable processes (Goldman 1979 and Bach 1985). Although he focuses primarily on externalist theories of knowledge, D. M. Armstrong’s “thermometer theory of knowledge” explains that certain mental states serve as reliable indicators or signs of knowledge, and therefore make the belief reasonable, or “justifiable.” Comparing non-inferential belief and a thermometer, Armstrong writes:

In some cases, the thermometer-reading will fail to correspond to the temperature of the environment. Such a reading may be compared to non-inferential false belief. In other cases, the reading will correspond to the actual temperature. Such a reading is like non-inferential true belief. (166)

There are a number of important qualifications to Armstrong’s view, but the central point is that a belief is justified independently of whether the person has reasons to believe it: “The subject’s belief is not based on reasons, but it might be said to be reasonable (justifiable), because it is a sign, a completely reliable sign, that the situation believed to exist does in fact exist” (183).

The benefit of Armstrong’s law-like account is that it suggests a counterfactual account of causal relations along the following lines: as long as a person has a means of distinguishing a proposition, P, from a mutually exclusive but very similar proposition Q, then the person is justified in believing P. For example, if Judy and Trudy are twins, and when John sees someone who looks like Judy, he would not mistake Trudy for Judy, then Sam is justified in believing that he sees Judy. “But if Sam frequently mistakes Judy for Trudy, and Trudy for Judy, he presumably does not have any way of distinguishing between them” (Goldman 1976: 778).

Unfortunately, reliable indicator theories tend to be overly strict in their analysis of cases. Goldman asks us to consider Oscar, who is standing in an open field and sees a Dachshund, from which he forms the belief that he sees a dog. As it happens, Oscar often mistakes certain dog breeds for wolves, who frequent the field. If he were to see a wolf, he might easily mistake it for a dog. Now, is his seeing a Dachshund a reliable indicator of seeing a dog? Since Oscar would likely believe he is seeing a dog regardless of whether he is seeing a wolf or a Dachshund, reliable indicator theories (at least Armstrong’s) would say his seeing a Dachshund is not a reliable indicator of seeing a dog. Whether this criticism is ultimately successful or whether it applies to all reliable indicator theories, reliable process theories quickly overshadowed interest in this type of reliabilism.

Process reliabilism is the view that a belief is justified just in case it is produced by a reliable cognitive process, where a cognitive process may include either conscious reasoning processes or unconscious mechanisms. As I formulated it earlier in this article, reliabilism is a necessary and sufficient condition for justification (“just in case”), but some reliabilists formulate weaker versions. Goldman treats it as a sufficient condition (though he argues against the plausibility of alternative sufficient conditions): “If S’s believing p at t results from a reliable cognitive belief-forming process (or set of processes), then S’s belief in p at t is justified,” (1979: 13). Kent Bach treats it as only a necessary condition: “The idea, roughly, is that to be justified a belief must be formed as the result of reliable processes…” (1985: 199). Despite these differences, externalists univocally reject internalist conditions as sufficient for justification. This commitment, however, leaves them open to a number of interesting criticisms.

c. Objections to Externalism

Though externalism, putatively, has the advantage of avoiding the Gettier problem (though this is controversial) and several other skeptical concerns and of capturing some important intuitions about knowledge, it faces several serious criticisms. On the basis of these criticisms, some internalists claim that externalists have simply changed the subject altogether and are not really talking about justification.

One famous criticism of externalism is called the generality problem. Earl Conee and Richard Feldman (1998) present an example to demonstrate the problem:

Suppose that Smith has good vision and is familiar with the visible differences among common species of trees. Smith looks out a house window one sunny afternoon and sees a plainly visible a nearby maple tree. She forms the belief that there is a maple tree near the house. Assuming everything else in the example is normal, this belief is justified and Smith knows that there is a maple tree near the house. Process reliabilist theories reach the right verdict about this case only if it is true that the process that caused Smith’s belief is reliable. (372)

Is it reliable? That depends on which process formed the belief. Was it the unique causal set of events leading to that particular belief? If so, it is not reliable, since token, or one-time, events have no historical track record. Reliabilists respond to this challenge by saying it is the type of process that must be reliable in order for a belief to be justified, not the token. If that is right, then we face the problem of determining which type of process formed the belief. Was it the “visually initiated belief-forming process,” the “process of a retinal image of such-and-such specific characteristics leading to a belief that there is a maple tree nearby,” the “process of relying on a leaf shape to form a tree-classifying judgment,” the “perceptual process of classifying by species a tree located behind a solid obstruction,” or any number of others (373)? There are innumerable options, and even if a combination of types were involved, each type would have to meet reliability conditions. Conee and Feldman conclude, “Without a specification of the relevant type, process reliabilism is radically incomplete” (373).

A second objection to externalism is called the New Evil Demon Problem (NEDP) (Cohen and Lehrer 1983). In Descartes’s original evil demon problem, in order to motivate the problem of skepticism, we are asked to consider the possibility that all our current perceptions are the fictitious construction of a being intent on deceiving us such that all our perceptual and intuitive beliefs are false. Putting the thought experiment to a very different purpose, if the evil demon world is possible, we can imagine two worlds: (1) a non-deceptive world, where our perceptions are reliably produced by the world outside of our minds, and (2) an evil demon world, where there are people just like you and me, who have exactly the same mental states that we do but whose perceptions are systematically unreliable—they track nothing of truth at that world. There are no trees, buildings, bodies, and so forth. Whatever actually exists at that world, those people have no perception of it. According to externalists—process reliabilists, in particular—the beliefs of people in the real world are justified and those of people in the demon world are unjustified, despite the fact that their mental lives are identical. Yet it is difficult to imagine that demon world beliefs about looking both ways before crossing the street and getting a second opinion about a medical diagnosis are unjustified. People who believe such things are acting responsibly from their perspective on their evidence. This suggests that reliabilism is not really about justification at all.

A third objection to externalism is what Ernest Sosa (2001) calls the metaincoherence problem, which attempts to show that a person’s belief can be externally reliable while internally unjustified. In the literature, there are two versions of the metaincoherence problem. The first is what I call first-order metaincoherence, which attempts to show that externalism is insufficient for justification. The second is what I call second-order metaincoherence, which challenges the externalist’s reasons for holding externalism.

One famous example of first-order metaincoherence is a thought experiment given in various forms by Laurence BonJour (1985) and Keith Lehrer (1990). Consider Armstrong’s Thermometer Analogy from above. Imagine there was a human thermometer, that is, someone who “undergoes brain surgery by an experimental surgeon who invents a small device which is both a very accurate thermometer and a computational device capable of generating thoughts” (Lehrer 1990: 163). This person, whom Lehrer names Mr. Truetemp, is unaware of the device despite the fact that it regularly causes him to form reliable beliefs that he unreflectively accepts about the temperature. On a given day, he might reliably form and accept the belief that it is 104 degrees Fahrenheit outside. Is this belief knowledge? Lehrer concludes: “Surely not. He has no idea whether he or his thoughts about the temperature are reliable” (164). BonJour concludes similarly, “Part of one’s epistemic duty is to reflect critically upon one’s beliefs, and such critical reflection precludes believing things to which one has, to one’s knowledge, no reliable means of epistemic access” (1985: 42).

The second-order metaincoherence problem is stated by Barry Stroud (1989):

The scientific ‘externalist’ claims to have good reason to believe that his theory is true. It must be granted that if, in arriving at his theory, he did fulfill the conditions his theory says are sufficient for knowing things about the world, then if that theory is correct, he does in fact know that it is. But still, I want to say, he himself has no reason to think that he does have good reason to think that his theory is correct. (321)

The worry is that, since externalists claim that features of the world outside the mental life of a believer ultimately determine whether a belief is justified, then, if externalism is true, externalists have no reason to believe it is true; in fact, they are committed to believing that whether their belief that it is true is justified is outside their ability to determine from within their own perspective. Again, the belief may be externally reliable, but it is internally unjustified.

If these criticisms hit their mark, epistemologists must make some difficult decisions about which approach—internalism or externalism—has the fewest or least pernicious problems. In the 21^st century, much work is underway to address these problems. If one remains unconvinced, there are recent developments that attempt to salvage some of the insights of internalism and externalism. A prominent example involves introducing character traits into the conditions for justification. We turn next to this view, called virtue epistemology.

8. Justification as Virtue

Classical theories of justification that imply a normative or belief-guiding dimension are modeled largely on normative ethical theories, whether teleological, or outcome-based, accounts or deontological, or duty-based, accounts. They ask whether people are rationally obligated to, permitted to, or obligated not to hold particular beliefs given their evidence. These are decision-based theories of rational normativity, as opposed to character-based theories. Just as virtue theory offers a non-decision-based alternative in ethics, it also suggests a non-decision-based alternative in epistemology. The attitudes and circumstances under which people form, maintain, and discard beliefs can be described as virtuous or vicious, and just as decision-based theories in epistemology are concerned with rational obligation (as opposed to moral obligation), character-based theories in epistemology are concerned either with intellectual character (as opposed to moral character), or with cognitive faculties understood as traits of a person (such as reason, perception, introspection, and memory). Of course, in matters of normativity, it is not a simple task to distinguish moral dimensions from rational or intellectual ones, but space prevents us from exploring that relationship here.

Virtue theories of justification hold that part of what justifies a belief is the intellectual traits with which a believer forms or holds the belief. Just as a person’s moral virtues contribute to the goodness of an action (kindness, compassion, honesty), a person’s intellectual virtues contribute to the epistemic goodness of a belief. Virtue theorists, however, are sharply divided as to which intellectual virtues are relevant. One prominent view is that justification is a function of those virtues that enhance reliability, that is, they have a strong external component (Sosa 1980; 2007). This view is known as virtue reliabilism.

A second prominent view is that justification is a function of those intellectual virtues that contribute to more general epistemic goods, including intellectual well-being, social trust, and the righting of epistemic injustice. These virtue responsibilists regard the truth-goal in epistemology very differently than both traditional epistemologists and their virtue reliabilist counterparts (Code 1984; Montmarquet 1993; Zagzebski 2000).

a. Virtue Reliabilism

A prominent version of virtue reliabilism is offered by Ernest Sosa (1980) in attempt to resolve the tension between foundationalists and coherentists. Sosa argues that if beliefs are grounded in truth-conductive intellectual virtues (where truth-conducive is conceived in process reliabilist terms), then foundationalists have empirically stable abilities or acquired habits that help explain the connection between sensory experience and non-inferential belief. Further, reliable virtues help explain how justification emerges from a coherent set of beliefs—coherence is a type of intellectual virtue.

What do these intellectual virtues look like for Sosa? Borrowing an example from his (2007), consider an archer who is aiming at a target. In order to be successful, the archer must have a degree of competence, which Sosa calls “adroitness,” and the shot must be accurate. These features are analogous to the epistemic state of having a true belief (accuracy) that is formed on the basis of good evidence (adroitness). These two features alone, though, are insufficient for the person to believe in the right way. The person must also exercise his adroitness in circumstances that increase his likelihood of having accurate beliefs, that is, his shot must be accurate because it is adroit. Sosa calls this third feature “aptness,” “its being true because competent” (2007: 23). Some of these circumstances will be outside the believer’s control—wind gusts in the archer’s case; causal ties to the world in the epistemic case. But some—for example, the virtues—are within the believer’s control.

Sosa explains:

Aptness depends on just how the adroitness bears on the accuracy. The wind may help some, for example…. If the shot is difficult, however, from a great distance, the shot might still be accurate sufficiently through adroitness to count as apt, though with some help from the wind. (2007: 79)

Notice that the role of the wind is analogous to certain external features of a person’s belief-forming state. Nevertheless, intellectual virtues like those mentioned above can increase one’s adroitness and thereby increase the likelihood of accuracy.

Imagine a person who has good evidence that P but who either does not appeal to that evidence when forming the belief that P, appealing instead to, say, wishful thinking, or who appeals to that evidence carelessly, refusing to consider alternatives or just how strong the evidence is. Despite this person’s having good evidence, her belief is not apt because the belief’s truth was not due to the person’s competence with the evidence.

Because of this external dimension, this branch of virtue epistemology is regarded as a form of reliabilism. Unlike externalist foundationalism, however, the reliability condition is not restricted to belief-forming processes; it is also highly dependent on context. Sosa says:

An archer might manifest sublime skill in a shot that does hit the bull’s-eye. This shot is then both accurate and adroit. But it could still fail to be accurate because adroit. The arrow might be diverted by some wind, for example, so that, if conditions remained normal thereafter, it would miss the target altogether. However, shifting winds might then ease it back on track towards the bull’s-eye. (79)

In epistemic cases, the believer must be suitably virtuous such that, under normal conditions, her beliefs are accurate because they are adroit.

b. Virtue Responsibilism

Sosa’s account has been well-received, though there is disagreement as to whether it is sufficient for solving the problems at issue. One prominent criticism is that Sosa does not take his use of virtues far enough. Rather than serving a more basic truth-goal, some argue that virtues should be conceived as central to the epistemic project.

Lorraine Code (1984) coined the term virtue responsibilism in contrast to Sosa’s reliabilism, and it is the view that justification, or rather, being an intellectually responsible agent, is a matter of acting virtuously in the practice of inquiry. Code argues that epistemic responsibility the central intellectual virtue. Similarly, James Montmarquet argues that, “S is subjectively justified in believing p insofar as S is epistemically virtuous in believing p” (1993: 99). This means that virtue responsibilism is internalist through and through.

Not all virtue responsibilists, however, eschew the truth-goal. As Linda Zagzebski explains, “It would not do any good for a person to be attentive, thorough, and careful unless she was generally on the right track” (2009: 82). But unlike externalist foundationalism, “the right track,” according to virtue epistemologists, does not necessarily include producing more true beliefs than false. There is more than one virtuous outcome, for example, in cases of creativity or inventiveness. It may be that “only 5 per cent of a creative thinker’s original ideas turn out to be true,” Zagzebski explains. “Clearly, their truth conduciveness in the sense of producing a high proportion of true beliefs is much lower than that of the ordinary virtues of careful and sober inquiry, but they are truth conducive in that they are necessary for the advancement of knowledge” (2000: 465). This suggests that the conditions under which a subject is justified are highly contingent on changing context and the goal of our epistemic behaviors. And virtue epistemologists argue that this captures the typical contingency of our epistemic lives.

c. Objections to Virtue Epistemology

In addition to internal disputes between virtue reliabilists and responsibilists, there are more serious concerns with the adequacy of virtue epistemology. Virtue reliabilism faces many of the same criticisms that face traditional reliabilism, including the generality problem, the New Evil Demon Problem, and the meta-incoherence problems. Further, although there is an intuitive sense in which a reliably functioning method of forming beliefs is virtuous (in the Aristotelian sense of “excellence”), it is not clear how virtue reliabilism is substantively different from classical reliabilism. To be sure, virtue responsibilists take special pains to explain the roles of context, luck, and the knower’s aptness in forming beliefs, but these do not seem unavailable to traditional reliabilists.

Similarly, virtue responsibilism faces many of the same problems as virtue ethics. There are questions about which intellectual states count as epistemic virtues (different responsibilists have different lists), whether some virtues should be privileged over others (for example, James Montmarquet (1992) argues that epistemic conscientiousness is the preeminent intellectual virtue), and the ontological status of virtues (whether they are real dispositions or simply heuristics for categorizing types of behavior). There are also serious concerns about some extreme versions of responsibilism that completely disconnect intellectual virtue from truth-seeking, as with Code’s account, rendering discussions of intellectual virtue the province of ethics rather than epistemology.

To alleviate some of these concerns, some virtue epistemologists defend a mixed theory, arguing that an adequate virtue epistemology requires both a reliability and a responsibility condition Greco (2000).

A general concern for both types of virtue epistemology is that virtue theory associates justification too closely with the idea of credit or achievement, whether a person has formed beliefs well. Jennifer Lackey (2007, 2009), for example, argues that if knowledge is produced by the virtuous activity of others (like that of a reliable witness) or if knowledge is innate, then it is not obvious how a person’s belief-forming behavior can be virtuous or vicious, as there is no behavior involved. In the case of the reliable witness, a hearer simply accepts on the basis of the witness’s testimony. In the case of innate knowledge, the knower does nothing to increase the likelihood that her beliefs are reliable; they are reliable for reasons outside her epistemic behavior. If these criticisms are right, virtue epistemology may be unable to explain a range of important types of knowledge.

For a more detailed treatment of virtue epistemology, see Virtue Epistemology.

9. The Value of Justification

Each of the theories of justification reviewed in this article presumes something about the value of justification, that is, about why justification is good or desirable. Traditionally, as in the case of Theatetus noted above, justification is supposed to position us to understand reality, that is, to help us obtain true beliefs for the right reasons. Knowledge, we suppose, is valuable, and justification helps us attain it. However, skeptical arguments, the influence of external factors on our cognition, and the influence of various attitudes on the way we conduct our epistemic behavior suggest that attaining true beliefs for the right reason is a forbidding goal, and it may not be one that we can access internally. Therefore, there is some disagreement as to whether justification should be understood as aimed at truth or some other intellectual goal or set of goals.

a. The Truth Goal

All the theories we have considered presume that justification is a necessary condition for knowledge, though there is much disagreement about what precisely justification contributes to knowledge. Some argue that justification is fundamentally aimed at truth, that is, it increases the likelihood that a belief is true. Laurence BonJour writes, “If epistemic justification were not conducive to truth in this way…then epistemic justification would be irrelevant to our main cognitive goal and of dubious worth” (1985: 8). Others argue that there are a number of epistemic goals other than truth and that in some cases, truth need not be among the values of justification. Jonathan Kvanvig explains:

[I]t might be the case that truth is the primary good that defines the theoretical project of epistemology, yet it might also be the case that cognitive systems aim at a variety of values different from truth. Perhaps, for instance, they typically value well-being, or survival, or perhaps even reproductive success, with truth never really playing much of a role at all. (2005: 285)

Given this disagreement, we can distinguish between what I will call the monovalent view, which takes truth as the sole, or at least fundamental, aim of justification, and the polyvalent view (or, as Kvanvig calls it, the plurality view), which allows that there are a number of aims of justification, not all of which are even indirectly related to truth.

b. Alternatives to the Truth Goal

One motive for preferring the monovalent view is that, if truth is not the primary goal of justification—that is, it connects belief with reality in the right way—then one is left only with goals that are not epistemic, that is, goals that cannot contribute to knowledge. The primary worry is that, in rejecting the truth goal, one is left with pragmatism. In response, those who defend polyvalence argue that, in practice, there are other cognitive goals that are (1) not merely pragmatic, and (2) meet the conditions for successful cognition. Kvanvig explains that “not everyone wants knowledge…and not everyone is motivated by a concern for understanding. … We characterize curiosity as the desire to know, but small children lacking the concept of knowledge display curiosity nonetheless” (2005: 293). Further, much of our epistemic activity, especially in the sciences, is directed toward “making sense of the course of experience and having found an empirically adequate theory” (ibid., 294). Such goals can be produced without appealing to truth at all. If this is right, justification aims at a wider array of cognitive states than knowledge.

Another argument for polyvalence allows that knowledge is the primary aim of justification but that much more is involved in justification than truth. The idea is that, even if one were aware of belief-forming strategies that are conducive to truth (following the evidence where it leads; avoiding fallacies), one might still not be able to use those strategies without having other cognitive aims, namely, intellectual virtues. Following John Dewey, Linda Zagzebski says that “it is not enough to be aware that a process is reliable; a person will not reliably use such a process without certain virtues” (2000: 463). As noted above, virtue responsibilists allow that the goal of having a large number of true beliefs can be superseded by the desire to create something original or inventive. Further still, following strategies that are truth-conducive under some circumstances can lead to pathological epistemic behavior. Amélie Rorty, for example, argues that belief-forming habits become pathological when they continue to be applied in circumstances no longer relevant to their goals (Zagzebski, ibid., 464). If this argument is right, then truth is, at best, an indirect aim of justification, and intellectual virtues like openness, courage, and responsibility may be more important to the epistemic project.

c. Objections to the Polyvalent View

One response to the polyvalent view is to concede that there are apparently many cognitive goals that fall within the purview of epistemology but to argue that all of these are related to truth in a non-trivial way. The goal of having true beliefs is a broad and largely indeterminate goal. According to Marian David, we might fulfill it by believing a truth, by knowing a truth, by having justified beliefs, or by having intellectually virtuous beliefs. All of these goals, argues David, are plausibly truth-oriented in the sense that they derive from, or depend on, a truth goal (David 2005: 303). David supports this claim by asking us to consider which of the following pairs is more plausible:

A1. If you want to have TBs [true beliefs] you ought to have JBs [justified beliefs].

A2. We want to have JBs because we want to have TBs.

B1. If you want to have JBs you ought to have TBs.

B2. We want to have TBs because we want to have JBs. (2005: 303)

David says, “[I]t is obvious that the A’s [sic] are way more plausible than the B’s. Indeed, initially one may even think that the B’s have nothing going for them at all, that they are just false” (ibid.). This intuition, he concludes, tells us that the truth-goal is more fundamental to the epistemic project than anything else, even if one or more other goals depend on it.

Almost all theories of epistemic justification allow that we are fallible, that is, that our justified beliefs, even if formed by reliable processes, may sometimes be false. Nevertheless, this does not detract from the claim that the aim of justification is true belief, so long as it is qualified as true belief held in the right way.

d. Rejections of the Truth Goal

In spite of these arguments, some philosophers explicitly reject the truth goal as essential to justification and cognitive success. Michael Williams (1991), for example, rejects the idea that truth even could be an epistemic goal when conceived of as “knowledge of the world.” Williams argues that in order for us to have knowledge of the world, there must be a unified set of propositions that constitute knowledge of the world. Yet, given competing uses of terms, vague domains of discourse, the failure of theoretical explanations, and the existence of domains of reality we have yet to encode into a discipline, there is not a single, unified reality to study. Williams argues that because of this, we do not necessarily have knowledge of the world:

All we know for sure is that we have various practices of assessment, perhaps sharing certain formal features. It doesn’t follow that they add up to a surveyable whole, to a genuine totality rather than a more or less loose aggregate. Accordingly, it does not follow that a failure to understand knowledge of the world with proper generality points automatically to an intellectual lack. (543)

In other words, our knowledge is not knowledge of the world—that is, access to a unified system of true beliefs, as the classical theory would have it. It is knowledge of concepts in theories putatively about the world, constructed using semantic systems that are evaluated in terms of other semantic systems. If this is, in fact, all there is to knowing, then truth, at least as classically conceived, is not a meaningful goal.

Another philosopher who rejects the truth goal is Stephen Stich (1988; 1990). Stich argues that, given the vast amount of disagreement among novices and experts about what counts as justification, and given the many failures of theories of justification to adequately ground our beliefs in anything other than calibration among groups of putative experts, it is simply unreasonable to believe that our beliefs track anything like truth. Instead, Stich defends pragmatism about justification, that is, justification just is practically successful belief; thus, truth cannot play a meaningful role in the concept of justification.

A response to both views might be that, in each case, the truth goal has not been abandoned but simply redefined or relocated. Correspondence theories of truth take it that propositions are true just in case they express the world as it is. If the world is not expressible propositionally, as Williams seems to suggest, then this type of truth is implausible. Nevertheless, a proposition might be true in virtue of being an implication of a theory, and so, for example, we might adopt a more semantic than ontological theory of truth, and it is not clear whether Williams would reject this sort of truth as the aim of epistemology.

Similarly, someone might object to Stich’s treating pragmatism as if it is not truth-conductive in any relevant sense. If something is useful, it is true that it is useful, even in the correspondence sense. Even if evidence does not operate in a classical representational manner, the success of beliefs in accomplishing our goals is, nevertheless, a truth goal. (See Kornblith 2001 for an argument along these lines.)

10. Conclusion

Epistemic justification is an evaluative concept about the conditions for right or fitting belief. A plausible theory of epistemic justification must explain how beliefs are justified, the role justification plays in knowledge, and the value of justification. A primary motive behind theories of justification is to solve the dilemma of inferential justification. To do this, one might accept the inferential assumption and argue that justification emerges from a set of coherent beliefs (internalist coherentism) or an infinite set of beliefs (infinitism). Alternatively, one might reject the inferential assumption and argue that justification derives from basic beliefs (internalist foundationalism) or through reliable belief-forming processes (externalist reliabilism). If none of these views is ultimately plausible, one might pursue alternative accounts. For example, virtue epistemology introduces character traits to help avoid problems with these classical theories. Other alternatives include hybrid views, such as Conee and Feldman’s (2008), mentioned above, and Susan Haack’s (1993) foundherentism.

11. References and Further Reading

• Aikin, S. 2009. “Don’t Fear the Regress: Cognitive Values and Epistemic Infinitism.” Think, 23, 55-61.
• Aikin, S. F. 2011. Epistemology and the Regress Problem. London: Routledge.
• Alston, W. P. 1988. “An Internalist Externalism,” Synthese, 74, 265-283.
• Alston, W. P. 1989. Epistemic Justification. Ithaca: Cornell University Press.
• Armstrong, D. M. 1973. Belief, Truth, and Knowledge. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Bach, K. 1985. “A Rationale for Reliabilism.” The Monist, 68, 246-63. Reprinted in S. Bernecker and F. Dretske, eds. 2000. Knowledge: Readings in Contemporary Epistemology. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 199-213. Cited pages are to this anthology.
• Bergmann, M. 2006. Justification Without Awareness. New York: Oxford.
• Blanshard, B. 1939. The Nature of Thought. London: Allen & Unwin.
• BonJour, L. 1980. “Externalist Theories of Empirical Knowledge.” Midwest Studies in Philosophy 5: Studies in Epistemology. Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press, 53-73.
• BonJour, L. 1985. The Structure of Empirical Knowledge. Cambridge: Harvard University Press.
• BonJour, L. and E. Sosa. 2003. Epistemic Justification: Internalism vs. Externalism, Foundations vs. Virtues. Malden: Wiley-Blackwell.
• Chisholm, R. 1966. Theory of Knowledge. Englewood Cliffs: Prentice Hall.
• Chisholm, R. 1982. “A Version of Foundationalism,” in The Foundations of Knowing, ed. R. Chisholm. Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press.
• Chisholm, R. 1989. Theory of Knowledge, 3^rd ed. Englewood Cliffs: Prentice Hall.
• Code, L. 1984. “Toward a ‘Responsibilist’ Epistemology.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 45 (1), 29–50.
• Cohen, S. and K. Lehrer. 1983. “Justification, Truth, and Knowledge.” Synthese 55 (2), 191-207.
• Conee, E. and R. Feldman. 2004. Evidentialism. New York: Oxford University Press.
• Conee, E. and R. Feldman. 1998. “The Generality Problem for Reliabilism,” in E. Sosa and J. Kim, eds. Epistemology: An Anthology. Malden: Blackwell Publishers, 372-386. Page numbers are to this anthology.
• Dancy, J. 1985. Introduction to Contemporary Epistemology. Oxford: Basil Blackwell.
• David, M. 2005. “Truth as the Primary Epistemic Goal: A Working Hypothesis,” in Contemporary Debates in Epistemology, eds. Mattias Steup and Ernest Sosa. Malden: Blackwell Publishing, 296-312.
• Davidson, D. “A Coherence Theory of Truth and Knowledge,” in E. Sosa and J. Kim, eds. Epistemology: An Anthology. Malden: Blackwell Publishers, 154-63.
• Elgin, C. 2005. “Non-foundationalist Epistemology: Holism, Coherence, and Tenability,” in Contemporary Debates in Epistemology, eds. Mattias Steup and Ernest Sosa. Malden: Blackwell Publishing, 156-67.
• Feldman, R. 1974. “An Alleged Defect in Gettier Counter-examples.” The Australasian Journal of Philosophy. 52, 68-69.
• Feldman, R. 1988. “Having Evidence,” in Philosophical Analysis, ed. D. F. Austin. Kluwer Academic Publishers, 83-104.
• Feldman, R. 2005. “Justification Is Internal,” in Contemporary Debates in Epistemology, eds. Mattias Steup and Ernest Sosa. Malden: Blackwell Publishing, 270-84.
• Fitelson, B. 2003. “A Probabilistic Measure of Coherence.” Analysis, 63, 194–199.
• Frankfurt, H. 1973/2008. Demons, Dreamers, and Madmen: The Defense of Reason in Descartes’s Meditations. Princeton: Princeton University Press.
• Gettier, E. 1963. “Is Justified True Belief Knowledge?” Analysis. 23, 121-23.
• Ginet, C. 2001. “Deciding to Believe,” in Knowledge, Truth and Duty, ed. Matthias Steup. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 63-76.
• Ginet, C. 2005. “Infinitism Is not the Solution to the Regress Problem,” in Contemporary Debates in Epistemology, eds. Matthias Steup and Ernest Sosa. Malden: Blackwell Publishing, 140-149.
• Goldman, A. 1967. “A Causal Theory of Knowing.” The Journal of Philosophy, 64, 357-72.
• Goldman, A. 1976. “Discrimination and Perceptual Knowledge.” The Journal of Philosophy, 73, 771-91.
• Goldman, A. 1979. “What Is Justified Belief?” in Knowledge and Justification, ed. George S. Pappas. Dordrecht, Holland: D. Reidel Publishing, 1-23.
• Greco, J. 2005. “Justification Is Not Internal,” in Contemporary Debates in Epistemology, eds. Mattias Steup and
• Ernest Sosa. Malden: Blackwell Publishing, 257-70.
• Haack, S. 1993. Evidence and Inquiry. Malden: Blackwell Publishing.
• Harman, G. 1986. Change in View. Cambridge: MIT Press.
• Heil, J. 1983. “Doxastic agency.” Philosophical Studies, 43 (3), 355-364.
• Hempel, C. 1935. “On the Logical Positivist’s Theory of Truth.” Analysis, 2 (4), 49-59.
• Klein, P. 2005. “Infinitism Is the Solution to the Regress Problem,” in Contemporary Debates in Epistemology, eds.
• Mattias Steup and Ernest Sosa. Malden: Blackwell Publishing, 131-40.
• Klein P. 2014. “No Final End in Sight,” in Current Controversies in Epistemology, ed. R. Neta. London: Routledge, 95-115.
• Klein, P. and T. A. Warfield. 1994, “What Price Coherence?” Analysis, 54, 129–132.
• Kornblith, H. 2001. Knowledge and Its Place in Nature. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Kvanvig, J. L. and W. D. Riggs. 1992. “Can a Coherence Theory Appeal to Appearance States?” Philosophical Studies, 67, 197-217.
• Kvanvig, J. 2005. “Truth Is not the Primary Epistemic Goal,” in Contemporary Debates in Epistemology, eds.
• Mattias Steup and Ernest Sosa. Malden: Blackwell Publishing, 285-96.
• Lackey, J. 2007. “Why we don’t deserve credit for everything we know.” Synthese, 158, 345–361.
• Lackey, J. 2009. “Knowledge and credit,” Philosophical Studies, 142, 27–42.
• Lehrer, K. 1974. Knowledge. Oxford: Clarendon Oxford Press.
• Lehrer, K. 1986. “The Coherence Theory of Knowledge.” Philosophical Topics, 14, pp. 5-25.
• Lehrer K. 1990. Theory of Knowledge. Boulder: Westview Press.
• Lewis, C. I. 1946. An Analysis of Knowledge and Valuation. LaSalle: Open Court.
• McGrew, T. 1995. The Foundations of Knowledge. Lanham: Rowman & Littlefield.
• Meinong, A. 1906. “Über die Erfahrungsgrundlagen unseres Wissens” [“On the Experiential Foundations of Our Knowledge”], in Abhandlungen zur Didaktik und Philosophie der Naturwissenschaften, Band [Vol.] I, Heft [Issue] 6, Berlin: J. Springer. Reprinted in Meinong 1968–78, Vol. V: 367–481.
• Montmarquet, J. 1987. “Epistemic Virtue.” Mind, 96, 482–497.
• Neurath, O. 1983/1932, “Protocol Sentences.” In R.S. Cohen and M. Neurath, eds. Philosophical Papers 1913–       1946. Dordrecht: Reidel.
• Olsson, E. J. 2009. Against Coherence: Truth, Probability, and Justification. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Plantinga, A. 1983. “Reason and Belief in God,” in A. Plantinga and N. Wolterstorff, eds. Faith and Rationality. Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press, 16-93.
• Plantinga, A. 1993a. Warranted Christian Belief. New York: Oxford.
• Plantinga, A. 1993b. Warrant: The Contemporary Debate. New York: Oxford.
• Pollock, J. 1986. Contemporary Theories of Knowledge. Lanham: Rowman & Littlefield Publishers.
• Poston, T. 2014. Reason and Explanation: A Defense of Explanatory Coherentism. Hampshire: Palgrave Macmillan.
• Quine, W.V.O. 1970. Web of Belief. Cambridge: Harvard University Press.
• Russell, B. 1948. Human Knowledge: Its Scope and Value. London: Routledge.
• Smithies, D. 2014. “Can Foundationalism Solve the Regress Problem?” in Current Controversies in Epistemology, ed. R. Neta. London: Routledge, 73-94.
• Sosa, E. 1980. “The Raft and the Pyramid: Coherence Versus Foundations in the Theory of Knowledge.” Midwest Studies in Philosophy, 5 (1), 3–26.
• Sosa, E. 1991. “Reliabilism and intellectual virtue” in Knowledge in Perspective: Selected Essays in Epistemology. New York: Cambridge University Press, 131-145.
• Sosa, E. 2001. “Reliabilism and Intellectual Virtue,” in Epistemology: Internalism and Externalism, ed. Hilary Kornblith. Malden: Blackwell Publishers, 147-62.
• Sosa, E. 2007. A Virtue Epistemology: Apt Belief and Reflective Knowledge, Volume 1. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Stich, S. 1988. “Reflective Equilibrium, Analytic Epistemology, and the Problem of Cognitive Diversity.” Synthese, 74, 391-413.
• Stich, S. 1990. The Fragmentation of Reason. Cambridge: The MIT Press.
• Stroud, B. 1989. “Understanding Human Knowledge in General,” in Knowledge and Skepticism, Marjorie Clay and Keith Lehrer, eds. Boulder: Westview, 31-50.  Reprinted in S. Bernecker and F. Dretske, eds. 2000.   Knowledge: Readings in Contemporary Epistemology. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 307-323. Page numbers to this anthology.
• Swain, Marshall. 1981. Reasons and Knowledge. Ithaca: Cornell University Press.
• Williams, M. 2000. “Epistemological Realism,” in Epistemology: An Anthology, eds. E. Sosa and J. Kim. Malden:     Blackwell Publishers, 536-555.
• Zagzebski, L. 1996. Virtues of the Mind: An Inquiry into the Nature of Virtue and the Ethical Foundation of Knowledge. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Zagzebski, L. 2000. “Virtues of the Mind,” in Epistemology: An Anthology, eds. E. Sosa and J. Kim. Malden: Blackwell Publishers, 457-467.
• Zagzebski, L. 2009. On Epistemology. Belmont: Wadsworth.

 

Author Information

Jamie Carlin Watson
Email: jamie.c.watson@gmail.com
Broward College
U. S. A.

Proper Functionalism

‘Proper Functionalism’ refers to a family of epistemological views according to which whether a belief (or some other doxastic state) was formed by way of properly functioning cognitive faculties plays a crucial role in whether it has a certain kind of positive epistemic status (such as being an item of knowledge, or a justified belief). Alvin Plantinga’s proper functionalist theory of knowledge has been the most prominent among these theories. Michael Bergmann’s (2006) proper functionalist theory of justification has also been the focus of much discussion. But proper functionalist theories of other epistemic properties have also been developed. Richard Otte (1987) and Alvin Plantinga (1993b: Chapter 9) offer proper functionalist theories of epistemic probability, for example. Nicholas Wolterstorff (2010) defends a proper functionalist theory of epistemic oughts. And Peter Graham (2010) develops a proper functionalist theory of epistemic entitlement. Since Plantinga’s theory of knowledge and Bergmann’s theory of justification are the most widely known and most discussed proper functionalist views, and because they share many features with other proper functionalist theories, this article focuses primarily on them—what can be said in their favor, the challenges they face, the ways in which they might be defended, and how they compare with some of their closest rivals.

Table of Contents

1. Plantinga’s Proper Functionalist Theory of Knowledge
   1. Motivations of Plantinga’s Theory
   2. The Content of Plantinga’s Theory
   3. Swampman
   4. Gettier Cases
2. Bergmann’s Proper Functionalist Theory of Justification
   1. Some Advantages of Bergmann’s Theory
   2. Some Objections to Bergmann’s Theory
3. Rival Theories
   1. Proper Functionalism and Phenomenal Conservatism
   2. Proper Functionalism and Virtue Epistemology
4. References and Further Reading

1. Plantinga’s Proper Functionalist Theory of Knowledge

This article begins with a discussion of Alvin Plantinga’s proper functionalist theory of knowledge. As Plantinga himself frames matters, he takes himself to be giving a proper functionalist theory of a property he calls “warrant,” where warrant is whatever precisely it is which makes the difference between knowledge and mere true belief.

a. Motivations of Plantinga’s Theory

A theory of warrant is subject to Gettier-style counterexamples if a belief can meet all the conditions the theory specifies as jointly sufficient for knowledge, but meet them merely by accident (in a manner that precludes that beliefs being an item of knowledge). Plantinga argues that any theory that fails to construe a proper function condition as necessary for warrant is subject to counterexamples of this sort. This is so whether the theory emphasizes the believer’s internal states as most relevant to whether her belief has warrant, external factors, or both of these.

By way of illustration, Plantinga (1993b: 31-37) adopts a scenario originally introduced by Roderick Chisholm, who attributes it to Alexius Meinong. The scenario envisions an aging forest ranger living in the mountains, with a set of wind chimes hanging from a bough. The ranger is unaware of the fact that his hearing has been degenerating of late, and it has gotten to the point where he can no longer hear the chimes. He is also unaware that he is occasionally subject to small auditory hallucinations in which he appears to hear the wind-chime. On one occasion, he is thus appeared to and comes to believe that the wind is blowing. As it happens, the wind is blowing and causing the ringing of the chimes. Even if we stipulate that all is going well with this belief from the ranger’s own internal perspective, it is clear nonetheless that his belief lacks warrant. The reason his belief lacks warrant, Plantinga maintains, results from the fact that it is due to cognitive malfunction.

One might question whether this explanation is correct, however, on the ground that certain cognitively external environmental conditions are also amiss in this case. In particular, the case is one in which there is no reliable connection between the ranger’s appearing to hear the wind-chime and the wind’s blowing. And one might think that it is primarily for this reason that the ranger’s beliefs lack warrant. This thought might push one toward bypassing proper functionalism and endorsing a reliabilist theory of warrant instead (that is, an account according to which a belief having warrant is primarily a matter of it being formed or sustained in a way that involves a reliable connection to the truth). But Plantinga also argues that any reliabilist theory which does not incorporate a proper function condition is also subject to Gettier-style counterexamples.

Plantinga (1993a: 195-198, 205-207) takes this to be illustrated by The Case of the Epistemically Serendipitous Brain Lesion. Imagine Sam has a brain lesion, one that engenders cognitive processes which mostly result in false beliefs. One process the lesion engenders, however, is a process that results in the belief that one has a brain lesion. This particular process is highly reliable (it always results in one’s having a true belief). But clearly the belief that results is not a matter of knowledge. What explains why this is so, Plantinga maintains, is that the belief in question (though formed by a truth-reliable process) is not the result of cognitive proper function. Accordingly, Plantinga concludes that any reliabilist account of warrant must be augmented with a proper function condition.

Kenneth Boyce and Alvin Plantinga (2012: 127-128) have emphasized that there may be an even stronger lesson to be drawn from these cases. Once these cases are on the table, one can imagine variations of them in which different combinations of internal and external conditions (other than proper function ones) are met, but in which the belief in question lacks warrant because it ends up being true merely by accident. Furthermore, Boyce and Plantinga contend that in these cases it seems that part of what explains why these are cases in which the beliefs are true merely by accident (in a way that precludes their being items of knowledge) is that they were not formed in a manner specified by cognitive proper function; that is, the way they get at the truth is accidental from the perspective of the cognitive design plan. If that is correct, however, then (as Boyce and Plantinga point out), there is reason to believe that the notion of cognitive proper function is centrally involved in the notion of non-accidentally that any adequate analysis of warrant must capture.

b. The Content of Plantinga’s Theory

Examples of the sort discussed above are used by Plantinga to motivate the claim that cognitive proper function is necessary for warrant. Plantinga (1993b: 21-24) also maintains that the relevant notion of proper function presupposes that of a design plan—something that specifies the manner in which a thing is supposed to function in various circumstances. As Plantinga conceives of it, a design plan may be modeled as a set of ordered triples, where each triple specifies a circumstance, a response, and a purpose or function. One need not initially take this notion of a design plan to involve conscious design or purpose. The notion of a design plan at issue here is whatever notion is presupposed by talk of proper function for biological systems (as when a physician determines that a human heart is functioning the way it is supposed to on account of its pumping at 70 beats per minute). Plantinga himself gives a theistic account of this notion, but other proper functionalists, such as Ruth Millikan (1984) and Peter Graham (2012), have offered naturalistic, evolutionary accounts.

While Plantinga (1993b: 46) takes cognitive proper function to be necessary for warrant, he does not take it to be sufficient (or even nearly sufficient). Other conditions must also be satisfied. To a rough, first approximation, Plantinga takes a belief to be warranted if and only if it satisfies the following four conditions:

(1) The belief in question is formed by way of cognitive faculties that are properly functioning.

(2) The cognitive faculties in question are aimed at the production of true beliefs.

(3) The design plan is a good one. That is, when a belief is formed by way of truth-aimed cognitive proper function in the sort of environment for which the cognitive faculties in question were designed, there is a high objective probability that the resulting belief is true.

(4) The belief is formed in the sort of environment for which the cognitive faculties in question were designed.

While Plantinga adds various nuances, these four conditions serve to capture the main outlines of his view.

Many objections have been raised to Plantinga’s theory. Two of the most prominent among them are considered below. The first amounts to an objection to the claim that Plantinga’s four conditions are necessary for warrant. The second amounts to an objection to the claim that they are sufficient. For a sampling of other objections, one would do well to examine the collection of essays on Plantinga’s theory of warrant edited by Jonathan L. Kvanvig (1996).

c. Swampman

Some have argued that there are counterexamples to Plantinga’s theory involving beings who have warranted beliefs but who nevertheless fail to exhibit cognitive proper function. The most well-known version of this objection comes from Ernest Sosa (1993), who adapts a scenario originally proposed by Donald Davidson, and uses it against proper functionalism. In that scenario, Davidson is standing next to a swamp when lightning strikes a nearby dead tree, thereby obliterating Davidson. Simultaneously, by sheer accident, the lightning also causes the molecules of the tree to arrange themselves into a perfect duplicate of Davidson as he was at the time of his demise. The Davidson duplicate—this “Swampman”—leaves the swamp, acting and talking as if it were Davidson, having all the same intrinsic properties that Davidson would have had, had he left the swamp without having his unfortunate encounter. According to Sosa, “it … seems logically possible for … Swampman to have warranted beliefs not long after creation if not right away” (p. 54). Yet, not being the product of intentional design, and not having any evolutionary history, it would seem that Swampman has no design plan. And so we have what appears to be a counterexample to proper functionalism.

There are various responses to the Swampman objection. Plantinga (1993c: 206-208) and Graham (2012: 466-467) have each argued, albeit for different reasons, that it is doubtful the Swampman scenario is metaphysically possible. They have also suggested, again for different reasons, that if this scenario is possible, perhaps Swampman can acquire conditions for proper functioning without natural selection or intentional design. See Plantinga (1993c: 78) and Graham (2014). Bergmann (2006: 147-149) has argued that we are intuitively inclined to assign positive epistemic status to Swampman’s beliefs only to the extent we are inclined to think that his beliefs are fitting responses to the inputs he receives. And we are inclined to think that Swampman’s beliefs are fitting, argues Bergmann, only to the extent we are inclined to think of those responses as exhibiting cognitive proper function. Boyce and Plantinga (2012: 130-131) have suggested that since it is merely by accident that Swampman is forming his beliefs reliably, we can think of this case as a Gettier scenario (or at least, relevantly analogous to one), and thereby deny that Swampman’s beliefs have warrant). For a similar response, see (McNabb 2015).

Since then, Kenneth Boyce and Andrew Moon (2015) have argued that the Swampman objection relies on a false intuition concerning the conditions under which the belief of one creature has warrant if the belief of another, similar creature does. According to them, the central intuition that motivates our intuitive reaction to the Swampman case may be stated as follows:

(CI) If a belief B is warranted for a subject S and another subject S* comes to hold B in the same way that S came to hold B in a relevantly similar environment to the one in which S came to hold B, then B is warranted for S*.

They argue that it is CI, in conjunction with the stipulation that Swampman forms his beliefs in the same way that an ordinary human being would (an ordinary human being to whom we would be inclined to attribute knowledge), that explains our tendency to regard Swampman as having warranted beliefs. Boyce and Moon then go on to argue that CI is subject to counterexamples, and that this undercuts the force of the Swampman objection. See Section 3b for further discussion of their argument.

d. Gettier Cases

Plantinga has conceded that his theory, as he originally formulated it, is subject to Gettier-style counterexamples. In 2000, Plantinga formulated this counterexample:

I own a Chevrolet van, drive to Notre Dame on a football Saturday, and unthinkingly park in one of the many places reserved for the football coach. Naturally, his minions tow my van away and, as befits such lèse majesté, destroy it. By a splendid piece of good luck, however, I have won the Varsity Club’s Win-a-Chevrolet-Van contest, although I haven’t yet heard the good news. You ask me what sort of automobile I own; I reply, both honestly and truthfully, “A Chevrolet van.” My belief that I own such a van is true, but ‘just by accident’ (more accurately, it is only by accident that I happen to form a true belief); hence it does not constitute knowledge. All of the non-environmental conditions for warrant, furthermore, are met. It also looks as if the environmental condition is met: after all, isn’t the cognitive environment here on earth and in South Bend just the one for which our faculties were designed?

Clearly Plantinga’s belief (though true) is not an item of knowledge in this case and thus lacks warrant. So Plantinga’s original four conditions are not jointly sufficient for warrant. Something else must be added. But what?

According to Plantinga, what the original account requires is an addition to the environmental condition. More specifically, the problem in the above case is that while the global environment that Plantinga is in is the one for which his faculties were designed, his more local environment is epistemically misleading. So in order to deal with this counterexample, Plantinga proposes adding a resolution condition. This condition involves a distinction between two different kinds of environment, what Plantinga refers to as the “maxi-environment” and what he refers to as the “mini-environment.” The maxi-environment, Plantinga stipulates, is the kind of global environment in which we live here on earth, the kind of environment for which our cognitive faculties were designed (or to which they were adapted). The mini-environment, by contrast, is a much more specific state of affairs, one that includes, for a given exercise of one’s cognitive faculties E resulting in a belief B, all of the epistemically relevant circumstances obtaining when B is formed (though diminished with respect to whether B is true).

Letting ‘MBE’ denote the cognitive mini-environment with respect to B and E (which Plantinga says may contain as large a fragment of the actual world as one likes, up to whether B is true), Plantinga maintains that the needed resolution condition may be stated as follows:

(RC) A belief B produced by an exercise of cognitive powers has warrant sufficient for knowledge only if MBE (the mini-environment with respect to B and E) is favorable for E.

This, of course, raises the question of just what it is for a mini-environment to be “favorable.” Plantinga has, in the past, offered various proposals for what favorableness consists in that he has subsequently admitted to be unsatisfactory. A proposal is found in Boyce and Plantinga (2012: 134). For other proposals, see Crisp (2000) and Chignell (2003).

2. Bergmann’s Proper Functionalist Theory of Justification

Plantinga’s theory of warrant is not the only kind of proper functionalist theory. Proper functionalist theories of other epistemic concepts have also been developed. Noteworthy among these is Michael Bergmann’s proper functionalist theory of epistemic justification. The kind of epistemic justification that Bergmann (2006: 4-5) is interested in is doxastic justification. The having of this property is frequently (though not universally) held to be a necessary condition for a belief being an item of knowledge. In fact, it is often held that a belief having this property, in conjunction with its being non-accidentally true (in a way that rules out Gettier cases), is not only necessary, but also sufficient, for its being an item of knowledge.

A major divide in the literature occurs between those philosophers who are “externalists” about this kind of justification and those who are “internalists” about it. Just how this divide should be characterized is itself a matter of dispute. But for present purposes, we may characterize internalists about justification as being committed (at least) to the view that whether a belief is justified depends entirely on which mental states that belief is based upon (in such a way that necessarily, any two believers who are exactly alike in terms of their mental states and in terms of which of those mental states their beliefs are based upon are also alike in terms of which of their beliefs are justified). Externalists, by contrast, maintain that whether a belief is justified may depend on other factors.

It should be noted, however, that Bergmann (2006: chapter 3) divides up the territory a bit differently, though not in a way that impacts the current discussion. He takes it to be a necessary condition for a view of justification to count as “internalist” that it include an awareness requirement (that is, that it require, in order for a belief to be justified, that the believing subject is actually or potentially aware of some justification-contributor to that belief). The characterization of internalism given here, by contrast, includes no such requirement (and is similar to the characterization of a view of justification that Bergmann calls “mentalism,” one which he takes to be distinct from both externalism and internalism).

As Bergmann (2006: 3-7) points out, it is not always clear that philosophers who appear to dispute the nature of justification are actually disagreeing with one another. That is because it is plausible that epistemologists sometimes use the term ‘justification’ in different ways. He notes, for example, that some epistemologists use this term to pick out a subjective notion, one that it is satisfied by a belief provided that the subject is blameless in holding it. Others, by contrast, he observes, use the term to pick out a more objective notion, one according to which a belief is justified only if it is fitting with respect to the believer’s evidence or other epistemically relevant inputs. It is this objective notion of justification in which Bergmann is interested (see also pp. 111-113). He takes it to be a conceptually open question as whether this kind of justification is necessary for knowledge (though he thinks it is). And he also takes some disputes between self-avowed externalists (like himself) and self-avowed internalists (such as Richard Feldman and Earl Conee) to involve a genuine disagreement concerning the nature of this kind of justification.

Bergmann argues that the right way to analyze this kind of justification is in terms of proper function. More specifically, Bergmann’s (2006: 132-137) theory of epistemic justification takes the first of Plantinga’s three conditions (leaving out the fourth, environmental condition) to be necessary for a belief to be justified. Bergmann also takes the first three of Plantinga’s conditions, in conjunction with the condition that the subject does not take the relevant belief to be defeated, to be sufficient for a belief being justified. The motivations for this view are perhaps best appreciated by looking to its purported advantages.

a. Some Advantages of Bergmann’s Theory

Epistemic justification of the kind Bergmann has in mind has some puzzling features. On the one hand, it involves some notion of truth-aptness. In particular, there would appear to be some important, non-trivial, connection between a belief being justified and it being objectively likely to be true. At the very least, it would be a significant cost for a theory of justification to deny this. But which ways of forming and sustaining beliefs result in a high proportion of true beliefs depends on what sort of environment one is in. Our tending to believe that occluded objects still exist, for example, results in a high proportion of true beliefs in our environment, but it is easy to imagine environments in which this would not be the case. These considerations push in the direction of regarding what makes for epistemic justification a contingent matter, one that depends on the sort of environment one inhabits.

On the other hand, justification is a normative concept, the satisfaction of which does not appear to depend on the sort of environment in which one is located. This aspect of justification is made especially vivid by “The New Evil Demon Problem”, originally put forward by Keith Lehrer and Stewart Cohen (1983), as a problem for reliabilist theories of justification. Consider a population of beings, just like ourselves, who form their beliefs in response to experience in just the ways that we do, but who (unlike us) are victims of a Cartesian demon who renders their belief-forming processes unreliable. From many reliabilist theories of justification, it follows that these beings have far fewer justified beliefs than we do (since most of their beliefs are not formed in a truth-reliable manner). But this seems false. These beings are in an epistemically bad situation, to be sure, but they are still forming their beliefs in ways that are appropriate given their experiences because their beliefs are at least justified.

Bergmann’s theory of epistemic justification nicely combines these puzzling features. First, it accommodates the intuition that inhabitants of a demon world, who are like us, and who form their beliefs in response to experience in the same ways we do, have the same proportion of justified beliefs. For, as Bergmann (2006: 141-143) notes, his theory entails that provided these beings have a cognitive design plan comparable to ours and are properly functioning, many of their beliefs are justified, even though their ways of forming beliefs are, for the most part, unreliable. This analysis also, as Bergmann points out, accommodates the intuition that justification is importantly and non-trivially connected with truth-aptness. For, insofar as the beings living in a demon world fulfill Bergmann’s conditions for justification, the manner in which they form their beliefs would be truth-apt if they were placed in the environment for which their cognitive faculties were designed. Finally, since different design plans may be tailored to different kinds of environments, Bergmann’s theory accommodates the possibility that what makes for justification is a contingent matter, one that depends on the kind of environment for which the creatures at issue are situated.

b. Some Objections to Bergmann’s Theory

Like Plantinga’s theory, Bergmann’s faces the objection that it is subject to counterexamples involving creatures like Swampman. There is no need, though, to rehearse the various responses that might be given to this objection here (since many of them will be the same or similar to those described in Section 1c). As a theory of justification, however, Bergmann’s view also faces other objections, ones which are not (or not as obviously) applicable to a theory of warrant.

Todd. R. Long (2012: 264-265) questions, for example, whether Bergmann’s theory does in fact do a better job than alternative views in handling the New Evil Demon Problem. He grants that Bergmann’s view does accommodate the intuition that demon-world victims with the same design plan as ours do in fact have justified beliefs (in the same proportions that we do). But he notes that Bergmann’s view also entails that the same cannot be said for demon-world victims who are mentally indistinguishable from ourselves but whose ways of forming beliefs run contrary to their design plan. And Long maintains that to deny that beliefs of demon-world victims in the latter situation are justified also runs contrary to our intuitions. Bergmann (2006: 150), however, anticipates an objection like this. He suggests that there is an analogy between Swampman and the demon victims in such a scenario; accordingly, he adapts his reply to the former so as to apply it to the latter.

Another kind of objection to a proper functionalist theory of justification involves cases in which the design plan specifies ways of belief formation that appear to be objectively bad in some way, in spite of the fact that this component of the design plan is successfully aimed at truth. Long (2012) and Tucker (2014b) each present variations of this objection directed specifically against Bergmann’s view. There are also precedents found among objections to Plantinga’s theory of warrant (see for example Feldman 1993: 44). There are at least two kinds of cases of this sort. The following discussion will make reference to cases described by Tucker, who provides examples of each kind.

In the first kind of case, the design plan specifies coming to hold a belief on the basis of what appears to be an objectively bad form of reasoning. Tucker (2014b: 3321-3322) presents a case, for instance, in which a design plan specifies coming to hold a certain belief on the basis of the fallacy of denying the antecedent. As Tucker points out, even though denying the antecedent is, from a logical point of view, an objectively bad form of reasoning, there are circumstances in which reasoning that way is reliable. So there is no reason in principle why a good, truth-aimed design plan could not specify forming a belief in that way, under the right conditions. Even so, it is counterintuitive to think that a belief formed by way of committing a logical fallacy could be justified (at least in the absence of having any further basis).

In the second kind of case, the design plan specifies coming to hold a belief on the basis of an input that intuitively fails to provide any kind of epistemic support for that belief. Tucker (pp. 3318-3319) presents an example, for instance, in which a person comes to believe Gödel’s incompleteness theorem solely on the basis of his belief that his students hate a particular type of beer. Since Gödel’s incompleteness theorem is a necessary truth, there is no question that this belief-forming process is reliable. So there is no reason in principle why a good, truth-aimed design plan could not specify that a belief be formed in this way. Even so, it seems wrong to say that someone could come to be justified in believing Gödel’s incompleteness theorem solely on the basis of that belief.

This is a formidable objection. But there may be things that can be said on the proper functionalist’s behalf. Consider once again the first kind of case, a case that involves coming to hold a belief in the basis of formally bad reasoning. Some things that have been said in defense of reliabilism might also be of use to the proper functionalist here. Alvin Goldman (2002: 146-153), for example, points to research on the part of cognitive psychologists (such as Amos Tversky and Daniel Kahneman) indicating that human beings tend to rely on heuristics when engaged in probabilistic reasoning. As is now well known, these heuristics make people prone to commit elementary probabilistic fallacies. The conclusion that some psychologists have drawn is that these findings indicate that human beings are terrible at probabilistic reasoning. But as Goldman notes, other psychologists have drawn a more optimistic conclusion.

Goldman points to the work of a group of evolutionary psychologists (led by Gerd Gigerenzer, Leda Cosmides, and John Tooby) who argue that, given the limited information and computational power with which organisms must contend, an inference mechanism can be advantageous if it (in Goldman’s words) “often draws accurate conclusions about real-world environments, and does so quickly and with little computational effort” (p. 152). The heuristics humans rely on in probabilistic reasoning, some of these psychologists maintain, are mechanisms of just that sort. If that is the case, then perhaps human beings often do come to hold justified beliefs by way of these mechanisms after all, in spite of the fact that they are formally suspect. And if that is so, then perhaps other kinds of beings might come to form justified beliefs on the basis of kinds of reasoning that (from a purely logical point of view) are formally suspect, but nonetheless reliable in the environments for which their cognitive faculties were designed.

Now consider the second kind of case, the case in which the design plan specifies coming to hold a belief on the basis of an input that intuitively fails to provide any kind of epistemic support for that belief. Why is it exactly (concerning Tucker’s example) that we are inclined to deny that a person’s belief that his students dislike of a particular type of beer could justify the belief that Gödel’s incompleteness theorem is true? Perhaps it is because there does not appear to be any interesting logical connection between the content of the latter belief and the belief on which it is based. But a similar observation concerning the relationship between our sense experiences and the content of our perceptual beliefs is part of what motivates Bergmann’s proper functionalist theory.

As Bergmann (2006: 119) points out, “Thomas Reid emphasized that there does not seem to be any logical connection between our sense experiences and the content of the beliefs based on them.” Bergmann notes, for example, that “the tactile sensations we experience when touching a hard surface seem to have no logical relation to (nor do they resemble) the content of the hardness beliefs they prompt.” Because this is so, Bergmann argues that the evidential support relations that hold between various sensory experiences and the beliefs formed in response to them cannot be explained in terms of necessary connections. But this prompts the question as to what does explain these support relations. Bergmann (2006: 130-131) argues that proper functionalism provides a good answer to this question. The connections are to be explained by way of which belief-forming responses to sensory inputs are specified by the cognitive design plan.

To accept this motivation for proper functionalism is to accept the claim that at least some epistemic support relations hold only contingently. It is also to countenance the possibility that the epistemic support relations that hold for certain cognizers might seem utterly bizarre from the perspective of creatures like us. So, perhaps, for those who do take this motivation on board, the possibility of an agent’s coming to justifiably believe that Gödel’s incompleteness theorem is true solely on the basis of a belief concerning the beer preferences of his students no longer seems so counterintuitive. (See Bergmann (2006: 141) for a similar response to BonJour’s purported counterexamples to externalist views of justification involving reliably formed clairvoyant beliefs).

3. Rival Theories

Proper functionalist theories do not exist in a vacuum. A full appreciation of their merits or demerits requires an investigation into how well they stack up against their rivals. Two kinds of theories in particular that are often put up against proper functionalism—phenomenal conservatism and virtue epistemology. It is sometimes claimed by the proponents of these theories that they satisfy many of the same motivations as proper functionalism, while having fewer costs, as well as other advantages.

a. Proper Functionalism and Phenomenal Conservatism

At least to a first approximation, a phenomenal conservative theory of doxastic justification may be characterized as the view that a belief with the content that p is justified for an agent if it seems to the agent that p, the agent appropriately bases her belief that p on that seeming, and the agent has no defeaters for that belief. (See Phenomenal Conservatism for more details). As noted in Section 2a, proper functionalists about justification point to the apparent contingency of the connection between various experiences and the beliefs they justify as a motivation for their view. Phenomenal conservatives sometimes claim that their view does just as well at accommodating this apparent contingency while preserving the claim that there is a necessary connection between the things that justify our beliefs and the beliefs they justify. For this reason, phenomenal conservatism might be thought to do a better job than proper functionalism in accommodating the New Evil Demon intuition. Some phenomenal conservatives have also contended that it does a better job in accounting for the nature of evidential support.

Tucker (2011: 58-63) presses this point in connection with his objection (discussed in Section 2b) that proper functionalism allows for inputs which intuitively fail to provide any kind of epistemic support for a belief to justify that belief. In the example previously discussed, Tucker pointed to an instance in which a belief served as such an input. But Tucker also supplies examples in which the same seems to be true of the support relations that hold between various sensory experiences and the beliefs they are purported to justify. He notes, for example, that it is counterintuitive to think that a sensory experience associated with seeing a beautiful sunset could justify the belief that Gödel’s incompleteness theorem is true. But a design plan (presumably different from ours) might well specify that this is an appropriate belief-forming process.

Here the proper functionalist might attempt once more to press the Reidian point that in general it appears true that there is no inherent connection between our sensory experiences and the contents of the beliefs based on them. But Tucker (2011: 56-58, 61-63) suggests a way the advocate of phenomenal conservatism could account for the role that sensory experience plays in justifying our beliefs that accommodates this fact. According to Tucker, sensory experience might play a role in the justification of a certain belief by triggering a seeming with the content of that belief, it being a contingent matter which sensations trigger which seemings. Andrew Cullison (2013: 34-37) makes a similar suggestion, noting that just as two different sentences from different languages might well express the same proposition, two different kinds of cognitive apparatus associated with different species might cause seemings of the same content in response to differing kinds of phenomenology. This accommodates the Reidian point while preserving the claim that there is a necessary connection between the things that justify our beliefs (that is, our seeming states) and the beliefs they justify (via the identities of their contents).

Suppose one agrees that a phenomenal conservative view of justification does better than a proper functionalist view on these counts. This of course does not commit one to agreeing that phenomenal conservatism does better than proper functionalism over all. Bergmann (2013) argues, for example, that proper functionalists can accommodate many of the intuitions that motivate phenomenal conservatism, while also doing a better job in accommodating the intuition that some belief formations, downstream from sensory experiences, are objectively fitting responses to those experiences, whereas others are not.

Bergmann notes, for instance, that proper functionalists might adopt a model according to which, for humans (though not necessarily for all cognizers), when all goes well, a belief formed in response to a sensory experience is justified via being based on an intermediate seeming (one that is appropriately caused by the experience). He argues that this model accommodates many of the intuitions to which phenomenal conservatives appeal. But it also, he points out, allows for the possibility that there is an objective mismatch between a belief formed in response to a sensory experience and the nature of that experience, one which prevents the belief in question from being justified, even when the content of that belief matches the content of the intermediate seeming.

Bergmann describes, for example, a case in which a human cognizer, suffering from brain damage, forms the belief that she is holding a hard spherical object, in response to the olfactory sensation she experiences while smelling a lilac bush. Even if it is stipulated that she bases this belief on an intermediate seeming with the same content as her belief, it can still seem that her belief is objectively unfitting (in relation to her experience) and, for that reason, unjustified. A proper functionalist can accommodate this intuition, Bergmann claims, whereas a phenomenal conservative cannot. The proper functionalist can maintain that the reason the cognizer’s belief is objectively unfitting in this case is that, even though it is based on an appropriate intermediate seeming, it is not the appropriate response to the relevant sensation; it is not the belief her design plan specifies should result.

Relatedly, one might think that proper functionalism does better than phenomenal conservatism in accounting for the relation between justification and truth-aptness. A common objection to phenomenal conservative views is that they suffer from a “cognitive penetration” problem. In certain kinds of wishful thinking cases, for example, a seeming state might be caused by a desire; and in some such cases the believer in question will be unaware of this fact, and have no defeater for the belief in question. According to phenomenal conservatives, a belief properly based on such a seeming will still be justified. But to many this seems wrong. One explanation for why this consequence seems wrong is that it threatens to radically undermine the connection between justification and truth. A proper functionalist, by contrast, might maintain that when such cognitively penetrated seemings are produced in human beings, this is due either to cognitive malfunction or to one of the non-truth aimed facets of our cognitive design plan (either of which, according to her view, would render the belief unjustified). See Tucker (2014a) however for an argument that proper functionalists also suffer from cognitive penetration problems.

b. Proper Functionalism and Virtue Epistemology

According to John Greco (1993: 414), “the central idea of virtue epistemology is that, Gettier problems aside, knowledge is true belief which results from one’s cognitive virtues.” Similarly, Sosa (1993: 64) characterizes it as consisting of a family of theories which may be seen as “varieties of a single more fundamental option in epistemology, one which puts the explicative emphasis on truth-conducive intellectual virtues or faculties.”

Virtue epistemology is often thought of as coming in at least two varieties. Virtue responsibilists emphasize character traits—intellectual virtues such as open-mindedness, conscientiousness, perseverance in seeking the truth, an so on. Virtue reliabilists emphasize cognitive faculties, abilities, or competencies. (See Virtue Epistemology for more details). Of these two, it is virtue reliabilism that is most akin to proper functionalism. Accordingly, virtue reliabilism serves as a closer competitor. Or rather, since Greco (1993: 414) and Sosa (1993: 64) have both classified proper functionalism as a version of virtue epistemology, perhaps it should be said that it is the non-proper-functionalist versions thereof which may be seen as close competitors. For ease of exposition, the following discussion will focus on Sosa’s development of such a version.

According to Sosa’s (2015: 10) virtue theory of knowledge, knowledge is “apt belief” where apt belief is “belief that gets it right through competence rather than luck.” More precisely, according to Sosa, an apt belief is a belief that sufficiently manifests an “epistemic competence” (that is, a competence to get at the truth) (p. 9), where “a competence is in turn understood as a disposition to succeed in a given field of aimings, these being performances with an aim, whether the aim be intentional and even conscious, or teleological and functional” (p. 2). Note the similarity to proper functionalism here. Sosa’s epistemic competences are akin to Plantinga’s truth-aimed cognitive faculties. Both involve the property of being aimed at the formation of true beliefs, and both (when all goes well) are exercised in a way that is conducive to the fulfilment of that aim.

One way in which Sosa’s epistemic competencies differ from Plantinga’s truth-aimed cognitive faculties, however, is that the former do not initially seem to presuppose any notion of a design plan. And this might make Sosa’s theory more adept at accommodating things like Swampman scenarios (see the discussion in Section 1c). Indeed, it was Sosa (1993) who made famous that objection to proper functionalism. It might also make Sosa’s view more appealing to those who are both naturalistically inclined and skeptical about the prospects for a naturalistically acceptable account of cognitive proper function.

Proper functionalists have called into question whether Sosa’s view does in fact have these advantages. Plantinga (1993c: 79) has argued, for example, that in order to handle the case of The Case of the Epistemically Serendipitous Brain Lesion (discussed in Section 1a), Sosa’s epistemic virtues must involve competencies or faculties that are subject to proper function conditions. If that is right, then, as Plantinga (p. 81) points out, Sosa’s view (developed so as not to be subject to this counterexample) becomes a variety of proper functionalism. It should be noted however that virtue epistemologists may have other ways of dealing with this case. John Greco (2010: 152) has suggested, for instance, that “in the brain lesion case, the problem is not so much a lack of health as it is a lack of cognitive integration.” “The cognitive processes associated with the brain lesion,” claims Greco, “are not sufficiently integrated with other of the person’s cognitive dispositions so as to count as being part of cognitive character.” Whether this reply is successful may turn on just what is necessary for a cognitive process to exhibit the kind of cognitive integration required. Greco (2010: 152) suggests his own, non-proper-functionalist criteria. But it is open to proper functionalists to argue that part of what is required is incorporation into one’s cognitive design plan.

Since then, Boyce and Moon (2015) argued that there are other kinds of cases that pose a challenge to the claim that a true belief manifesting a competence is sufficient for its being an item of knowledge. As noted in Section 1c, Boyce and Moon propose a counterexample to what they regard as the central intuition underlying the Swampman Objection to proper functionalism. Their counterexample employs some of the cognitive science literature on initial knowledge, which supports the claim that human beings sometimes come to know things by way of innate, unlearned cognitive responses (see for example Spelke, 1994). Drawing from this literature (as well as from Bergmann, 2006:116-121), Boyce and Moon argue that some of these innate responses are merely contingently appropriate ways of forming beliefs (where the appropriateness at issue is of a kind necessary for warrant). They argue that while these responses are appropriate for human beings, given the kind environments to which humans are adapted, the same need not have been true for other kinds of beings.

Boyce and Moon then go on to argue that these facts entail there are possible cases involving two cognitive agents, who are members of different species, coming to hold the same belief, in the same way, in the same environment, but in which that belief is warranted for one of them (on account of its resulting from a way of forming beliefs that is appropriate for members of that species) but not the other. They further argue that not only do these cases furnish counterexamples to the central intuition motivating the Swampman objection to proper functionalism, but that they also provide a challenge to alternative theories. Boyce and Moon suggest, for instance, that they afford potential counterexamples to Sosa’s theory, at least insofar as it does not recognize factors such as proper function conditions or species membership as relevant to competence possession.

Proper functionalists point to the kinds of cases alluded to above as lending support to the view that a belief having arisen by way of cognitive proper function is necessary for it to count as an item of knowledge. It should be acknowledged, however, that virtue epistemologists have pointed to other kinds of cases in which the opposite seems true. John Greco (2010: 151-153) has noted, for example, that there appear to be “cases of improper function that actually increase a person’s capacity to know.” Greco cites various cases documented by the neurologist Oliver Sacks (1970) in order to illustrate this point. “An obvious example,” says Greco, “is the story of autistic twins, who enjoyed incredible mathematical abilities associated with their autism.” Another case is that of “a man whose illness resulted in an increase in detail and vividness regarding childhood memory.” So much so, Greco notes, that when “these memories were put to use in accurate and detailed paintings of the man’s hometown in Italy…the man came to be considered an expert on the layout and appearance of that town, even though he had not visited there in decades.” Greco claims that these are cases in which “dysfunction gave rise to knowledge.”

What might a proper functionalist say in response to these scenarios? A couple of strategies are suggested by Plantinga (1993c: 74-75) in a reply to Richard Feldman (1993: 48-49). Feldman also points to these kinds of cases as creating difficulties for proper functionalism; in particular, Feldman cites the case of the autistic twins described above. As Feldman notes, these twins had the ability to “just see” (apparently without counting) that the number of matches that had fallen out of a box was 111. In his reply, Plantinga further notes that these same twins could also “just see,” it seems, whether a given six or eight digit number was prime. The first strategy Plantinga suggests for dealing with these cases is to call into question whether the individuals involved really do acquire knowledge in the scenarios described. The second is to concede (at least for the sake of argument) that they do, but argue that this is consistent with proper functionalism.

Regarding the first strategy, Plantinga notes that while the twins mentioned above can in fact reliably identify prime numbers, they lack, according to Sacks, the concept of multiplication. But if the twins lack the concept of multiplication, Plantinga argues, it is not clear that they genuinely grasp the concept of a prime number; so it is not clear that they have the relevant beliefs. Plantinga concedes, however, that this is a less plausible thing to say regarding the twins’ ability to discern the number of matches that had fallen out of a box. Here Plantinga turns to the second strategy. He concedes that while the twins’ “faculties obviously seem to malfunction in some ways,” it is doubtful that they are malfunctioning in producing the belief that there are 111 matches on the floor. Plantinga suggests that, perhaps, the twins have a different design plan than that of other human beings, and that this belief-forming tendency of theirs is subject to proper function conditions. In support of this claim, he notes that it seems possible that this remarkable ability of theirs might become damaged (in such a way that it is no longer reliable); in that case, he contends, we would be inclined to say that this ability had malfunctioned.

Another possibility open to the proper functionalists is to concede that these are cases in which cognitive malfunction enables the acquisition of knowledge, but only by way of truth-aimed proper function. If a typical human being, as a result of cognitive malfunction, suddenly found it seeming to her that she could just see that 111 matches had fallen out of a box, we might doubt that she really knows there are 111 matches. We might think that this belief, formed by way of this new-found tendency of hers, fails to count as knowledge, unless or until she has independent confirmation that the tendency is reliable. Once she does have such confirmation, we might concede that the resulting beliefs do count as knowledge, but only because she learned this to be a reliable way of getting at the truth. So perhaps, in at least some of the cases at issue, the individuals in question do acquire knowledge via belief-forming tendencies resulting from cognitive malfunction, but only by way of having learned those tendencies to be reliable. And if this learning occurs by way of cognitive processes that are in accord with proper function, these cases pose no difficulties for a proper functionalist theory.

This is perhaps not a plausible thing to say regarding all of these cases, however. It is not as plausible a thing to say regarding the individual whose illness caused him to form detailed memorial beliefs pertaining to his hometown in Italy, for example. One reason this a less plausible thing to say concerning that case is that the person in question is (presumably) forming these beliefs in response to memory phenomenology, which is an epistemically appropriate way for human beings to form beliefs downstream from experience. We would be much less likely to judge this person as having knowledge if these same beliefs arose, say, in response to the kind of phenomenology associated with a vivid daydream, unaccompanied by memorial seemings, even if the resulting beliefs should turn out to be reliably formed. So, the proper functionalist might say, if cognitive malfunction is somehow enabling the acquisition of knowledge in this case, it is not by virtue of causing the subject to respond deviantly to his experience (since, in that regard, he is responding as proper function dictates). It must, rather, be by virtue of its causing some deviation upstream from experience (that is, by virtue of its producing an abnormality in the manner in which the subject’s memorial experiences are produced). Whether this creates a significant problem for proper functionalism, furthermore, may depend on just how the malfunction in question enables knowledge.

However exactly memory information is processed, stored, and retrieved so as to generate belief-producing memorial experiences, it is plausible that the cognitive system responsible (or set of systems responsible) has different functions associated with it. One of these functions is to generate experiences that reliably produce true beliefs. But no doubt there are other functions associated with this system that do not pertain to that goal (indeed, some may even be in tension with it). It is plausible, for instance, that some of those functions pertain to filtering information as it comes in, either by preventing some of that information from being stored in the first place, discarding some of that information after it has been stored, or preventing some of it from being encoded in the relevant experiences. The purpose of this filtration process might not be to secure the production of true beliefs, but to prevent various kinds of information overload, or to highlight important items information at the expense of discarding others. Plausibly, what occurs in the case at issue is that a malfunction results in the suppression of these kinds of functions, leaving various other truth-aimed functions associated with the production of the relevant memorial experiences intact.

This consideration suggests yet another possible strategy the proper functionalist might have for dealing with these kinds of cases. Yes, she might grant, some of these are cases in which cognitive malfunction enables knowledge, but not by way of interfering with truth-aimed cognitive proper function (at least not with respect to the process that issued in the relevant beliefs). In at least some of these cases, the malfunction enables knowledge by preventing various non-truth-aimed aspects of cognitive proper function from interfering with or dampening various truth-aimed aspects (or perhaps by preventing some truth-aimed aspects of cognitive proper function from interfering with or dampening various other truth-aimed aspects). The consequence is that certain truth-aimed aspects of cognitive proper function result in various items of knowledge they would not have otherwise produced. So even though these are cases in which cognitive malfunction enables knowledge, the proper functionalist might say, they are not counterexamples to the claim that knowledge itself must come by way of truth-aimed cognitive proper function. Or, she might insist, to the extent to which it is unclear that these purported items of knowledge come by way of truth-aimed cognitive proper function, it is also unclear that we should count them as genuine items of knowledge.

It should pointed out that many virtue theories of knowledge also quite naturally lend themselves to virtue theories of justification. As Sosa (2007: 22-23) points out, for instance, an agent can manifest skill in a performance even when that performance fails to achieve its aim or achieves it merely by luck. An archer might take a skillful shot (to use one of Sosa’s frequent analogies), for instance, while still missing the target (or hitting it only by luck) on account of erratic wind conditions. Similarly, a believer might manifest her skill at coming to hold true beliefs while nonetheless getting it wrong (or getting it right only by luck) on account of being in an epistemically bad environment. Under these circumstances, the belief in question may be said (in Sosa’s terminology) to be “adroit” but not “apt” (p. 23). A belief that is adroit, according to Sosa, may be said to be justified (in one good sense at least) even if it is not an item of knowledge (BonJour and Sosa: 2003: 157).

A Sosa (2015: 26-27) himself is well aware, the having of a skill presupposes something like a normal environment. As Sosa points out, we do not say that a person lacks driving skill merely because she is disposed to perform poorly on an icy road in the midst of a snowstorm. What matters is whether she is disposed to perform well under ordinary driving conditions. Similarly, what matters for whether an agent is skilled at coming to hold true beliefs is whether she is capable of doing so in a certain kind of environment. But which sort of environment is the relevant one? According to Bergmann, this question points to an area in which a proper functionalist theory of justification has the advantage.

As Bergmann (2006: 142-143) notes, in a 1991 work  Sosa takes justification to be relativized to an environment. The person in the demon world has justified beliefs relative to our environment, according to this view, but not relative to her own. Similarly, the beliefs of alien cognizers who have radically different methods of belief formation than we do (ones that are adapted to their own environment) may have beliefs that are justified relative to their environment but not relative to ours. Bergmann argues however that our ordinary concept of justification does not appear to be relativized in this way.

In later work, as Bergmann also points out, in 2003 Sosa  holds that there are two different senses in which a belief might be said to be justified. A belief is “adroit-justified” if the method by which it is formed is reliable in the actual world, and “apt-justified” if the method by which it is formed is reliable in the subject’s world. As Bergmann notes, however, this view does not account for our intuition that there is a single sense in which our beliefs, the alien cognizers’ beliefs, and the demon victims’ beliefs are all justified.

Proper functionalism, by contrast, Bergmann maintains, has no difficulty accommodating these intuitions, since it holds that the relevant environment is the one specified by the design plan (which is the same between us and the demon victims but different for the alien cognizers). Whether Bergmann points to a genuine advantage of his theory over Sosa’s in this regard has, however, been disputed. Markie (2009: 374-377) argues, for example, that Bergmann’s own theory faces disadvantages akin to those he attributes to Sosa’s.

As with most disputed views, the extent to which one is drawn to proper functionalist theories will depend in large measure on which intuitions one has, the relative weight one assigns to them, one’s assessment of how well the theories in question accommodate those intuitions, and whether their rivals do any better. And here one’s mileage may vary. But it is a safe bet that proper functionalist theories will continue to serve as serious contenders for the foreseeable future.

4. References and Further Reading

• Bergmann, Michael. 2006. Justification Without Awareness: A Defense of Epistemic Externalism (Oxford: Oxford UP).
• Bergmann, Michael. 2013. “Externalist Justification and the Role of Seemings” Philosophical Studies 166: 163-184.
• BonJour, Laurence and Sosa, Ernest. 2003. Epistemic Justification: Internalism vs. Externalism, Foundations vs. Virtues (Malden, MA: Blackwell Publishing).
• Boyce, Kenneth and Plantinga, Alvin. 2012. “Proper Functionalism” The Continuum Companion to Epistemology, ed. Andrew Cullison (London: Continuum International Publishing Group).
• Boyce, Kenneth and Moon, Andrew. 2015. “In Defense of Proper Functionalism: Cognitive Science Takes on Swampman,” Synthese Online First: DOI 10.1007/s11229-015-0899-6. http://link.springer.com/ article/10.1007/s11229-015-0899-6.
• Crisp, Thomas M. “Gettier and Plantinga’s Revised Account of Warrant” Analysis 60: 42-50.
• Chignell, Andrew. 2003. “Accidentally True Belief and Warrant” Synthese 137: 445-458.
• Cullison, Andrew. 2013. “Seemings and Semantics” Seemings and Justification, ed. Chris Tucker (Oxford: Oxford UP).
• Feldman, Richard. 1993. “Proper Functionalism” Nous 27: 34-50.
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Author Information

Kenneth Boyce
Email: boyceka@missouri.edu
University of Missouri
U. S. A.

The Aim of Belief

It is often said that belief has an aim. This aim has been traditionally identified with truth and, since the late 1990s, with knowledge. With this claim, philosophers designate a feature of belief according to which believing a proposition carries with it some sort of commitment or teleological directedness toward the truth (or knowledge) of that proposition. This feature is taken to be constitutive of belief (that is, it is part of what a belief is that it is an attitude having this aim) and individuative of that type of mental state (that is, it is sufficient for distinguishing beliefs from other types of mental attitude like desire and imagining). Philosophers appeal to belief’s aim mainly for explanatory purposes: the aim is supposed to explain a number of other features of belief, such as the impossibility of believing at will, the infelicity of asserting Moorean sentences (for example, “I believe that it is raining, but it is not raining”), and the normative force of evidential considerations in the processes of belief-formation and revision.

Though many tend to agree on the above aspects of the aim, there are major disagreements over two further issues: (1) how to interpret the claim that belief has an aim, and (2) what this aim is. With respect to (1), the claim has received very different interpretations. Some have interpreted it literally, taking the aim as an intentional purpose of believers or a functional goal of beliefs; others have interpreted it metaphorically, as some kind of commitment or norm governing beliefs and their regulation (formation, maintenance, and revision); still others deny that beliefs aim at truth in a substantive sense and endorse minimalist accounts of belief’s truth-directedness. With respect to (2), there is an ongoing debate on whether the aim of belief is truth, knowledge, or some other condition such as epistemic justification.

Table of Contents

1. The Truth-Directedness of Belief
   1. The Aim as Constitutive and Individuative of Belief
   2. Differences between the Aim and Other Properties of Belief
   3. The Explanatory Role of the Aim
2. Interpretations of the Aim
   1. Teleological Interpretations
   2. Normative Interpretations
   3. Minimalist Interpretations
3. What Does Belief Aim At?
4. Relevance of the Topic
5. References and Further Reading

1. The Truth-Directedness of Belief

The claim that “belief aims at truth” was first coined by Bernard Williams (1973) to designate a set of properties of beliefs, namely (1) that truth and falsehood are dimensions of assessment of beliefs as opposed to other psychological states and dispositions; (2) that to believe that p is to believe that p is true; and (3) that to say “I believe that p” carries, in general, a claim that p is true; that is, it is a qualified way of asserting that p is true (Williams, 1973, p. 137).

Since Williams, many have taken up the claim that belief aims at truth. However, with such an expression, these philosophers do not refer to a set of properties as Williams did, but to a unique feature of belief (sometimes also called truth-directedness). This feature (that is, aiming at truth) is supposed to capture the specific relation of belief with truth. This relation seems to be peculiar to belief, and to play an important role in the characterization of this type of attitude. No other attitude seems to entertain such a special relation with truth. Like belief, the content of attitudes like (propositional) desires, imaginings, and mere thoughts can be true or false. But differently from these attitudes, beliefs are considered defective if their content is false, or correct if it is true: if I imagine that snow is black, there is nothing defective in my imagination; but if I believe that snow is black, there is something wrong with my belief. Also, we can arbitrarily decide to form or revise attitudes like imagining and assuming regardless of whether we take their contents to be true or false, but this seems not to be possible for beliefs. In short, these attitudes are not sensitive to truth-regarding considerations in the way beliefs are (in both normative and descriptive ways). The relation of belief with truth also differs from that of factive attitudes like knowledge and regret. Differently from beliefs, these attitudes imply the truth of their content. If I know that it is raining now in Paris, then it is true that it is raining now in Paris. But if I believe that, the content of my belief may be false. The relation of belief to truth is thus neither as weak as that of other attitudes like imagining, nor as strong as that of knowledge. This is why it is often conceived as an aim or a commitment toward the truth (or knowledge) of the believed proposition: beliefs may fail to be true (to achieve that aim), not that they may fail to aim at truth.

That granted, a further question is how to interpret the claim that beliefs aim at truth. Philosophers conceive of truth-directedness in very different ways: as an intentional aim of the believer to accept a proposition if and only if it is true; as a function regulating our cognitive processes; as a norm requiring one to believe a proposition only if true; as a value attached to believing truly. In this section I remain neutral on the specific interpretations of the aim, postponing a discussion of these interpretations to §2. The objective of the present section is to introduce some properties commonly attributed to truth-directedness, independent of its specific interpretation. For ease of exposition, it will also be assumed that truth is the aim of belief until §3, where alternative candidates are considered.

Section 1.a introduces two properties commonly attributed to truth-directedness: (1) that it is a constitutive or essential feature of belief, and (2) that it is individuative of belief with respect to other mental attitudes. Section 1.b considers the differences between truth-directedness and other truth-related properties of belief such as the direction of fit and the value of having true beliefs. The truth-aim is usually attributed to belief in order to explain a number of characteristics of this attitude concerning its relation with truth. Section 1.c lists the main features that truth-directedness is supposed to explain.

a. The Aim as Constitutive and Individuative of Belief 

When philosophers attribute an aim to belief, they conceive of this property as constitutive of this type of attitude. This means, roughly, that it is part of what a belief is (that is, part of the essence or the concept of belief) that it is a mental attitude directed at the truth. Let us label this the constitutivity thesis. Depending on how we conceive truth-directedness, there will be different ways of working up to this thesis. If, for example, we interpret truth-directedness as a goal of the agent (compare §2.a), we can conceive of beliefs as analogous to acts like concealing (Steglich-Petersen, 2006, p. 512). Part of what it is to conceal an object X is that it is a type of act involving the goal that someone will not find X. It is in virtue of this goal that an action counts as an instance of concealing. Similarly, a way of stating the constitutivity thesis for belief is that it is part of what S’s believing that p is that S has an aim or goal (or that it is a function of S’s cognitive system) to retain that attitude only if it is true. It is in virtue of this aim of the agent who believes (or this function of her cognitive system) that that attitude counts as belief.

Alternatively, if one interprets truth-directedness as a norm to believe only the truth (compare §2.b), the constitutivity thesis amounts to understanding this norm by analogy to rules constitutive of practices like games (Wedgwood, 2002, p. 268). A practice is constituted by a set of rules if and only if it is part of what that practice is that this set of rules is in force for agents engaged in that practice (Glüer & Pagin, 1998). Consider a specific example: chess is a game constituted by a set of rules stating which moves are legal or permissible in the game. If one plays chess, one is thereby committed by the rules of the game to perform only legal moves. The performance of a particular act does not count as a chess-move if it cannot be assessed (justified, criticized…) according to the constitutive rules of the game. Similarly, if it is part of what a belief is that it is an attitude governed by a norm to believe only the truth, a mental attitude does not count as a belief if it cannot be assessed (criticized, justified…) on the basis of this norm, as right or correct if true and wrong or incorrect if false. One can also conceive of the constitutivity thesis by analogy to other types of entity essentially constituted by norms or values. For example, it is constitutive of what it is to be a citizen to be subject to certain rights and commitments, and it is constitutive of murder to be an act of killing in a wicked, inhumane, or barbarous way (for the latter example, see Dretske, 2000, pp. 243-245).

The claim that truth-directedness is constitutive of belief can be conceived of in at least two ways, as relative to the concept of belief or to its nature. According to the conceptual interpretation, it is a condition of understanding the concept of belief that we conceive of beliefs as mental attitudes directed toward truth (Boghossian, 2003; Engel, 2004; Shah, 2003). A proper understanding of the concept of bachelor implies conceiving of a bachelor as an unmarried man. Analogously, if one has a correct grasp of the concept of belief and conceives of a mental attitude as a belief, she understands it as one that, in some sense to be specified, is directed toward truth.

Other philosophers consider truth-directedness as constitutive of the nature or essence of belief (Brandom, 2001; Railton, 1994; Velleman, 2000a; Wedgwood, 2002, 2007). The relation between belief and truth-directedness is here conceived of as one of metaphysical dependence of the former on the latter: as it is essential to water that it has a certain chemical composition (H₂O), it is essential to belief that it is an attitude involving a commitment to or an aim at truth. A mental attitude counts as a belief at least partially in virtue of aiming at the truth. It is simply impossible for an attitude to be a belief if it lacks this property.

It is usually held that the essentialist interpretation of the thesis does not entail the conceptual one (for example, Wedgwood, 2007, ch. 6). It is part of the essence of water, but not of its concept, that water is H₂O—we can understand the concept of water without conceiving water as having that specific chemical composition. Similarly the truth-aim may be constitutive of the essence of belief but not of its concept (see Zangwill, 2005 for a similar view). Also, some philosophers have argued that the conceptual interpretation does not entail the essentialist one (Papineau, 2013; Shah, 2003, fn. 41; Shah & Velleman, 2005, fn. 43; Wedgwood, 2007).

The second property commonly attributed to truth-directedness is the individuativity of belief: the aim is the feature that individuates belief as that type of mental state and distinguishes beliefs from other mental attitudes (Engel, 2004; Lynch, 2009; Railton 1994; Velleman, 2000a; Wedgwood, 2002). Though many other attitudes entertain relations with truth (compare §1.b), it is claimed that belief is the only attitude aiming at truth. The truth-aim plays a fundamental role in sorting out beliefs from other mental attitudes, being the distinctive feature of beliefs with respect to other types of attitude like thoughts, suppositions, desires, and imagining.

Philosophers usually appeal to the individuativity of truth-directedness for belief for two main reasons: (1) singling out the aim as a peculiarly distinctive property of belief helps to achieve a better grasp of what truth-directedness is and to distinguish this property from other properties of belief (a philosopher who assumes individuativity in order to define truth-directedness is Velleman, 2000a, pp. 247-252); and (2) individuativity provides an argument to the best explanation for the claim that belief aims at truth: as the argument goes, without assuming that belief’s truth-directedness has this peculiar individuative role, one cannot account for the difference between beliefs and other attitudes (Engel, 2004; Railton, 1994).

It has also been suggested that if truth-directedness is the distinctive feature of belief with respect to other mental attitudes, this would provide an argument for the claim that this property is also constitutive of belief (Lynch, 2009b, 81; McHugh & Whiting, 2014; Velleman, 2000a; Wedgwood, 2002). Here is a way in which this argument may proceed: if the truth-aim were not a necessary and constitutive feature of belief, it would be possible for a belief not to aim at truth. But then, assuming that the aim is the only feature distinguishing beliefs from other mental attitudes, it would be impossible to classify that attitude as a belief rather than as a different type of attitude. Thus, the truth-aim must be a feature that beliefs possess necessarily and essentially. The argument from individuativity is not the only one supporting the constitutivity of truth-directedness for belief. Since other arguments partially depend on normativist interpretations of the aim, they will be considered in 2.b.

A number of critics have pointed out that it is possible to distinguish beliefs from other types of attitude without stipulating that it involves a constitutive aim at truth. These philosophers identify the attitude of believing a proposition with that of merely holding it true or accepting it (Glüer & Wikforss, 2013; Vahid, 2009), or they take other dispositional or motivational properties of belief as distinctive of this type of attitude. For a discussion of some of these views see §2.c.

b. Differences between the Aim and Other Properties of Belief

According to many philosophers engaged in the present debate (in particular those endorsing teleological and normative interpretations), truth-directedness is supposed to characterize and distinguish belief from other types of mental attitude. This property is conceived of as unique to belief, not possessed by any other attitude. These philosophers are careful to distinguish it from other properties relating belief to truth that other attitudes also possess. In this subsection I will introduce some of these properties and explain in which respects they are supposed to differ from the aim of belief. Mentioning these other properties will provide a rough idea of what truth-directedness is not. However, before considering these properties, it is worth mentioning that some philosophers endorsing minimalist conceptions of truth-directedness tend to identify the aim with some of these properties; these alternative interpretations of the aim will be briefly mentioned in this subsection and considered in more detail in §2.c.

An obvious truth-related feature of belief is the fact that believing something is believing it to be true (Velleman, 2000a). In other words, beliefs have propositions as content, and propositions can be true or false. This property is obviously not individuative of belief, and thus cannot be identified with truth-directedness. All propositional attitudes share it with beliefs. For instance, believing that p is believing that p is true, hoping that p is hoping that p is true, imagining that p is imagining that p is true, and so on (Engel, 2004; Velleman, 2000a).

It is also commonly held that beliefs involve specific causal, functional, and dispositional-motivational roles with respect to action and behavior. Some of these roles determine another aspect under which beliefs are related to truth. Using Ramsey’s (1931) metaphor, beliefs are like maps by which we steer in the world and upon which we are disposed to act. Belief is an attitude involving dispositions to act and behave as if its content were true and to use it as premise in reasoning (Armstrong, 1973; Stalnaker, 1984). Some have argued that belief’s aim at truth can be identified with the possession of similar dispositional and functional properties. In response to this challenge, it has been argued that these properties are not sufficient to set belief apart from other mental attitudes, and thus to capture the distinctive relationship between belief and truth (Engel, 2004; Velleman, 2000a). Other types of attitude seem to possess these very same properties. For instance, attitudes like acceptance and pretense all seem to dispose the subject to act as if their content were true and have the same motivational role.

Another property commonly attributed to belief, and concerning the way it is related to truth, is its mind-to-world direction of fit. On the one hand, some attitudes, like desires, have a world-to-mind direction of fit: if what is desired is not the case, the world should be changed in order to fit what is desired, and not vice versa. On the other hand, other attitudes, like beliefs, have a mind-to-world direction of fit: if what is believed is not the case (that is, it does not fit what it is supposed to represent), the belief’s contents should be revised to fit the world, and not vice versa. This is only one way of fleshing out the distinction (see Frost, 2014 and Humberstone, 1992 for overviews of the distinction). Another popular way is to distinguish between cognitive and conative states, where cognitive states are such that the proposition in their content is regarded as something that is true, while conative states are such that they involve regarding the proposition in the content as something to be made true (Velleman, 2000a). It is difficult to evaluate the relation of the truth-directedness of belief with direction of fit, since this depends on which account of direction of fit one accepts, and there is no unique and undisputed account. Some philosophers seem to identify belief’s direction of fit with its aim at truth (Humberstone, 1992; Platts, 1979). Others (Engel, 2004; Shah & Velleman, 2005; Velleman, 2000a) distinguish the two features, arguing that other mental attitudes such as suppositions, assumptions, and imagining possess the same direction of fit as beliefs, and thus this property cannot be identified with truth-directedness, which is distinctive of beliefs. Notice that the persuasiveness of this argument depends on whether one endorses an account of direction of fit according to which other attitudes would have the same direction of fit as belief.

It is also important to distinguish the truth-directedness of belief from the value of possessing true beliefs. It has been argued that having true beliefs is something valuable (David, 2005; Horwich, 2006; Kvanvig, 2003; Lynch, 2004). We naturally prefer to have true rather than false beliefs, and tend to attribute some sort of value to true beliefs and disvalue to false ones. It seems to be a platitude that true beliefs are at least extrinsically and instrumentally valuable. For example, we might prefer true beliefs to false ones because the former are more conducive to the satisfaction of one’s desires and the avoidance of dangers. Some philosophers have argued that true beliefs have also epistemic value. For example, it has been argued that believing the truth is an intrinsically valuable cognitive success. Though one might expect there to be important connections between the two topics, the issue of whether true beliefs are valuable must be distinguished from the further issue of whether truth is the aim of belief. While the former is a matter of aims, goals, and evaluations extrinsic to the notion of belief (for example, the goal of believing truths and not believing falsehoods), the latter is a property intrinsic and constitutive of such a mental state (Vahid, 2006, 2009, p. 19). Another respect in which the two features must be distinguished is that the value of true beliefs is hardly individuative of beliefs: other types of mental state such as guesses, hypotheses, and conjectures are evaluable according to their being true or false. In spite of these important differences, some philosophers have suggested that the value of true beliefs can be at least in part related to and explained by the constitutive aim of belief, even if not identified with it (Engel, 2004; Lynch, 2004 Railton, 1994; Williams, 2002).

c. The Explanatory Role of the Aim

The hypothesis that beliefs involve an aim at truth has been used to explain a number of features specific to this mental attitude. Before considering such features, it is important to stress that not everyone who endorses some version of this hypothesis thinks that it can explain all of these features. The main features supposed to be explained by truth-directedness are the following:

• The difficulty or impossibility of believing at will,
• The infelicity of asserting Moorean sentences and the absurdity of having Moorean beliefs,
• The normativity of mental content,
• The motivational force of evidential considerations in deliberative contexts,
• The nature of epistemic normativity and the norms governing belief and theoretical reasoning, and
• The correctness standard of belief.

(1) As famously argued by Williams (1973), belief’s truth-aim would enable one to explain the difficulty of believing at will (see also Velleman, 2000a). Believing a proposition p at will would entail believing it without regard to whether p is true. However, if beliefs constitutively involve aiming at truth, the only considerations relevant to forming and maintaining a belief would be those in conformity to its constitutive aim; that is, truth-relevant considerations. Believing at will would thus be either impossible or very difficult. This line of argument has been widely discussed in the literature. For critical discussions see, for example, Frankish (2007); Hieronymi (2006); Setiya (2008); and Yamada (2012).

(2) Belief’s truth-directedness could also explain the infelicity of asserting Moorean sentences and the absurdity of thinking Moorean thoughts—sentences and thoughts having the form “I believe that p, but not p” (for example, Baldwin, 2007; Littlejohn, 2010; Millar, 2009; Moran, 1997; Railton, 1994). Though these sentences are not self-contradictory, if asserted, they sound odd and infelicitous. As Moore (1942, p. 543) observes, this feature of belief-ascription seems to show that self-ascribing a belief in the first person carries with it an implied claim to the truth of the believed proposition. Similar ascriptions relative to many other mental states involve either no infelicity (there is no paradox in asserting “I assume that p but it is false that p”) or a contradiction (it is contradictory to assert “I know that p but it is false that p”). The infelicity of asserting Moorean sentences can be explained as follows: on the one hand, an assertion is an act by which the speaker commits herself to the truth of what she says; on the other hand, a belief is a mental state involving an aim at the truth of the believed proposition. We can also think of this aim as a sort of commitment (Baldwin, 2007; Millar, 2009; see §2.a for normative interpretations of the aim). The infelicity would thus be due to a conflict between the respective constitutive commitments or aims of assertion and belief. By asserting a Moorean sentence like “p and I do not believe that p,” a speaker would both endorse a commitment to the truth of p and deny such a commitment at the same time. This explanation can be easily extended to an explanation of the unreasonableness of Moorean thoughts and judgments, since a judgment, like an assertion, can be considered an act involving a commitment to the truth of what is adjudged.

(3) Many philosophers argue that mental content is normative (for an overview and references, see Glüer & Wikforss, 2010). This thesis is often interpreted as the claim that there are norms governing the correct use of concepts in the content of propositional mental attitudes. An example of such norms is, for instance, that the concept white is correctly applied to an object x if and only if x is white. Some have suggested that the aim of belief can provide an explanation of the normativity of mental content. In particular, Velleman (2000a) has suggested that the normativity of content can be entirely reduced to the truth-directedness of belief: if there is a norm governing mental content, this norm applies only to the contents of attitudes that aim at truth; that is, to beliefs. Boghossian (2003) has provided an argument according to which the normativity of mental content would derive from that of belief. First, he argues that the truth-directedness of belief has to be conceived as a norm constitutive of the concept of belief. Second, he argues that there is a constitutive connection between the notions of content and belief: our grasp of the concept of content depends on the grasp of the concept of belief. The normativity of content would thus be inherited by the normativity of belief. This argument has been the target of several criticisms; see, in particular, Glüer & Wikforss (2009) and Miller (2008).

(4) Belief’s truth-directedness has also been invoked to explain certain aspects of doxastic deliberation (namely deliberation concerning what to believe). One such aspect is the motivational force of evidential considerations in deliberative contexts. In particular, Shah (2003) and Shah and Velleman (2005) have argued that truth-directedness can explain doxastic transparency, the phenomenon according to which, in the context of doxastic deliberation, the question whether to believe that p is invariably settled by the answer to the further question whether p is true. Roughly, the idea is that when an agent engages in deliberation whether to believe a given proposition, only evidential (truth-regarding) considerations can be treated as reasons for believing. Other types of considerations (for example, practical) have no motivational force in the deliberation. This can be explained by the hypothesis that the concept of belief is constitutively governed by a norm to believe p only if p is true, and that in doxastic deliberation, the agent deploying that concept in the question whether to believe that p is motivated by the truth-norm to form a belief only if it is true. This in turn explains why only truth-relevant considerations matter in answering the question. Other philosophers have provided similar explanations of doxastic transparency—and more generally of the central role of evidence in deliberative belief-formation processes—compatible with non-normative interpretations of the truth-aim (for example, Steglich-Petersen, 2006, §5). It is worth noting here that similar explanations of the impossibility of believing in response to non-evidential considerations can also be used to explain the impossibility of believing at will (see (1) above).

(5) Belief’s aim has also been invoked to explain the various norms governing belief and theoretical reasoning, and to shed light on the nature of epistemic normativity in general. For example, according to Velleman, belief’s truth-directedness accounts for the justificatory force of theoretical reasoning. Theoretical reasoning justifies a belief by adducing considerations that indicate it to be true (2000a, p. 246). This is the case because being true is what satisfies the aim of belief. Other philosophers have argued that belief’s aim helps to explain norms of rationality and justification governing beliefs, and, more generally, the nature of epistemic normativity (Boghossian, 2003; Millar, 2004, 2009; Shah & Velleman, 2005; Sosa, 2007; Wedgwood, 2002, 2013). A common explanation takes these norms as instrumentally conducive to the satisfaction of the constitutive truth-aim of belief. This approach to epistemic normativity is not new in the literature. Many philosophers of the past have argued that epistemic standards of justification and rationality would be derivable from the fundamental goal of believing truly and avoiding falsehoods (for an overview see Alston, 2005, chs. 1 and 2). Criticisms of this type of approach to epistemic normativity typically mirror arguments against similar approaches in the practical domain. See, for example, Berker (2013); Firth (1981); Kelly (2003); and Maitzen (1995).

The various attempts to reduce or explain epistemic normativity in terms of a fundamental aim or norm of truth governing belief are considered by some philosophers as part of a wider project directed at providing analogous accounts for other normative domains. In particular, some have argued that practical normativity can be tracked back to constitutive norms of action and agency, which in turn would determine derivative norms of practical rationality and justification (Korsgaard, 1996; Shah, 2008; Velleman, 2000a; Wedgwood, 2007).

(6) According to some philosophers, the aim at truth would also explain why a belief is correct if and only if it is true, that is, the so-called correctness standard of belief (Steglich-Petersen, 2006, 2009; Velleman, 2000a). Philosophers endorsing teleological interpretations of the aim hold that the standard would be an instrumental assessment indicating the measure of success that a belief must attain in order to achieve its constitutive aim. However, this thesis is the subject of major disagreements. Philosophers giving normative interpretations of truth-directedness either identify the correctness standard with the constitutive aim of belief (Engel, 2007; Wedgwood, 2002), or argue for the independence of the two (Shah & Velleman, 2005).

2. Interpretations of the Aim

In the contemporary debate, there is a wide disagreement on how to interpret the claim that belief aims at truth. There are two main interpretations of the aim: teleological and normativist. According to teleological accounts, the aim of belief is an intentional purpose of subjects holding beliefs, or a functional goal of cognitive systems regulating the formation, maintenance, and revision of beliefs. Normativist accounts hold that the claim that beliefs have an aim must be interpreted metaphorically. According to normativists, truth-directedness is better understood as a commitment, a norm governing the regulation of beliefs (their formation, maintenance, and revision). Other philosophers have endorsed minimalist accounts of truth-directedness, denying that beliefs aim at truth in a substantive sense.

a. Teleological Interpretations

Teleological (also called “teleologist”) interpretations hold that beliefs are literally directed at truth as an aim, an end, or a goal (telos in Greek). This aim would be realized in truth-conducive processes and practices of belief-regulation, whose role is the formation, maintenance, and revision of beliefs. An attitude would count as a belief only if it is formed and regulated by these processes and practices. An advantage commonly attributed to teleological interpretations is that these interpretations seem more compatible with a naturalistic account of belief than rival interpretations (in particular, normativist ones). The thought is that intentions, goals, or functions can be accounted for in naturalistic terms. Furthermore, this interpretation would naturally fit with broadly instrumentalist, naturalistically unproblematic conceptions of epistemic normativity and epistemic rationality (note however that these conceptions have been the target of many criticisms; for example, Berker, 2013; Kelly, 2003).

Teleological interpretations differ with respect to how they conceive the aim at truth. Some teleologists interpret the aim of belief as an intentional goal of the subject, like an interest to accept a proposition only if it is true. For example, according to Steglich-Petersen (2006), believing is accepting a proposition with the purpose of getting its truth-value right. According to such an interpretation, the aim is realized through deliberative practices like judgments, in which an agent accepts a proposition only if she has evidence in support of its truth, and maintains that acceptance in the absence of contrary evidence. Steglich-Petersen recognizes that many of our beliefs are regulated in entirely sub-intentional ways. However, he argues that only beliefs considered at an intentional level are connected to a literal aim:

cognitive states and processes that are not connected with any literal aim or intention of a believer can nevertheless count as ‘beliefs’ in virtue of […] being to some degree conducive to the hypothetical aim of someone intending to form a belief in the primary strong sense. (2006, p. 515)

Other philosophers have advanced sub-intentional interpretations of the aim, conceiving it as a functional goal of the attitude or the psychological system to form true beliefs and revise false ones. This function would be regulated at a sub-personal, often unconscious level. A similar approach has been defended by Bird (2007) and McHugh (2012b). Some authors also interpret certain functionalist accounts such as those of Burge (2003), Millikan (1984), and Plantinga (1993) as teleological in this sense (see, for example, McHugh, 2012a, fn. 6, 2012b, fn. 49).

The most popular interpretation of the aim is a “mixed” one, according to which truth-directedness would be constituted by both intentional and sub-intentional processes. In particular, Velleman (2000a) maintains that there is a broad spectrum of ways in which the aim can be regulated. While sometimes it is realized in the intentional aim of a subject in an act of judgment about a certain matter, at other times there are cognitive systems in charge of the regulation of belief designed to ensure the truth of such mental states. Such systems would carry out this function more or less automatically, not relying on the subject’s intentions. Other philosophers who distinguish between intentional and sub-personal levels of regulation of the aim are Millar (2004, ch.2); Sosa (2007, 2009).

A well-known objection to teleological accounts, provided by Owens (2003), is specifically directed at intentional and mixed interpretations of the aim (for similar objections see Kelly, 2003). Owens observes that if beliefs aim at truth as argued by teleologists, believing would be similar to guessing. Guesses are mental acts aiming at truth, in the sense that when one guesses, one strives to give the true answer to a question. As Owens writes,

a guesser intends to guess truly. The aim of a guess is to get it right: a successful guess is a true guess and a false guess is a failure as a guess. Someone who does not intend to guess truly is not really guessing. (2003, p. 290)

 According to a teleologist perspective, similar considerations are valid for belief, which is a mental state held with the purpose of holding it only if true. But there are at least two important disanalogies between the intentional aim involved in guessing and the aim of belief.

First, the aim of belief does not interact with other aims of the subject the way the truth-aim of guesses does. The aim of guessing (as well as that of other goal-directed activities) can interact with other goals and objectives of the subject, it can conflict with these other goals, and it can be weighed with them. In particular, when we guess, we integrate the truth-aim constitutive of guessing with other purposes, such as the practical relevance of guessing, and we consider guessing that p reasonable when aiming at the truth by means of a guess that p would maximize expected utility (Owens, 2003, p. 292). If beliefs, like guesses, constitutively involve an aim at truth, then we should expect that, on at least some occasions, we would weigh the aim of belief against other aims. For example, when engaged in deliberation about whether to believe a given proposition, our pursuit of the truth-goal may be constrained by other goals and purposes of the subject in the usual way. But belief’s aim does not work like this. A large reward to believe that today it is not sunny gives me a reason to try to believe it, but, in deliberation about what to believe, these considerations do not interact and cannot be weighed with the truth-aim of belief in the way they do with other aims and purposes of the subject. In this respect, belief appears to be “insulated” from all but one aim, in a way that aim-directed behaviors in general are not (McHugh, 2012a, p. 430).

The second disanalogy suggested by Owens is that, in guessing, we can exercise a kind of voluntary control that is not possible in the case of belief. The guesser can compare different considerations and then decide whether to terminate her inquiry and guess. Nothing similar happens in deliberation about whether to believe a given proposition, where one cannot decide when to conclude her inquiry and start believing a proposition. The deliberation is concluded more or less automatically and cannot be controlled by reflection on how best to achieve the aim. Given these disanalogies, Owens concludes that while a guess is an attitude regulated by an intentional aim at truth, belief is not.

Teleologists have provided some replies to Owen’s argument. In particular, it has been argued that the aim of belief does in fact interact and can be weighed with other aims (Steglich-Petersen, 2009); it has been denied that evidential considerations play the exclusively prominent role in belief-formation suggested by Owen’s argument (McHugh, 2012a; for a similar point, though not directly related to Owen’s argument, see Frankish, 2007); and it has been argued that the direct form of control we have on the formation of guesses, but not of beliefs, can be explained by the fact that belief is a mental state, while guessing is a mental act (Shah & Velleman, 2005).

A related problem for a teleological interpretation of the aim is that sometimes we are completely indifferent to certain matters, and sometimes we even prefer (have the goal or aim) not to have any belief on certain matters. Nevertheless, evidence for these truths constitutes reasons for us to believe them, and if presented with such evidence in normal circumstances, we cannot refrain from forming beliefs on these matters. This seems to show that truth-directedness, and more generally epistemic rationality, cannot be reduced to aim-directed activities in the common sense of the term (Kelly, 2003).

Another very popular argument against teleological accounts of truth-directedness is Shah’s (2003) “teleologist’s dilemma”. The dilemma relies on the following observation: on the one hand, in practices of doxastic deliberation—deliberation directed at forming a belief about a certain matter—considerations concerning the evidence in support of the truth of a given proposition are the only ones that are relevant in order to answer the question whether to believe that proposition (this is what Shah calls the phenomenon of doxastic transparency; compare §1.c). On the other hand, some belief-formation processes can be influenced by non-evidential factors (for example, cases of wishful thinking). In an attempt to explain these two types of belief formation, the teleologist is pushed in two incompatible directions: she can consider the truth-aim as a disposition so weak as to allow cases in which beliefs are caused by non-evidential processes, in which case she cannot account for the exclusive influence of evidential considerations in deliberative contexts of belief-formation; alternatively, in order to account for the exclusive role of evidence in doxastic deliberation, she can strengthen the disposition that constitutes aiming at truth so that it excludes the influence of non-truth-regarding considerations from such kinds of reasoning—but then she cannot accommodate non-deliberative cases in which non-evidential factors influence belief-formation. In either case, the teleologist cannot explain the truth-regulation of belief in both deliberative and non-deliberative contexts. Therefore, a teleologist interpretation of the aim is not sufficient alone to provide an explanation for the truth-directedness of beliefs in all processes of belief formation.

In order to address this problem, Shah & Velleman (2005) argue that belief is regulated by two levels of truth-directedness: a sub-intentional teleological mechanism responsible for weak regulation in non-deliberative contexts, and one conceived in normative terms, able to explain the strong truth-regulation in deliberative contexts (see §2.b). For accounts of the dilemma compatible with a teleologist perspective, see, for example, Steglich-Petersen (2006) and Toribio (2013). For other objections to the teleological account, see Engel (2004) and Zalabardo (2010).

b. Normative Interpretations

Another way of interpreting belief’s truth-directedness has been through normative terms. According to normativist accounts of the aim of belief, the claim that “belief aims at truth” is just a metaphorical way of expressing the thought that beliefs are constitutively governed by a norm prescribing (or permitting) one to believe the truth (or only the truth). For example, if Mary forms the belief that it is now 12 a.m., she does what the norm requires (that is, she possesses a right belief) if that proposition is true, and she violates the norm if that proposition is false. Many normativists identify the norm of belief with a standard of correctness:

(C) a belief is correct if and only if the believed proposition is true

These philosophers take this standard to be constitutive of the essence or the concept of belief: belief would be a mental state characterized by the fact of being correct if and only if it is true (see §1.a for more details on normativist interpretations of the constitutivity thesis). This interpretation of the aim is probably the most popular in the early 21^st century. It has been defended by, among others, Boghossian (2003); Engel (2004, 2013); Gibbard (2005); Millar (2004); Shah (2003); Wedgwood (2002, 2007, 2013).

Let us here clarify a common confusion about the claim that belief is constitutively governed by a norm: that a truth-norm constitutively governs belief does not mean that all beliefs necessarily satisfy that norm. What is constitutive of belief is not the satisfaction of the norm (as a matter of fact, many beliefs happen to be false, and thus incorrect), but that the norm is in force and believers and their beliefs can be assessed and criticized according to it—as correct if the belief is true, and incorrect if it is false.

One of the best known arguments for a normative interpretation of truth-directedness, suggested by Shah (2003), is the argument to the best explanation of doxastic transparency. As mentioned in §2.a, transparency is the (alleged) phenomenon according to which the deliberative question whether to believe a given proposition p is invariably settled by answering the further question whether it is true that p. The two questions are answerable to the same set of considerations; that is, considerations concerning the evidence for or against the truth of p. This phenomenon is specific to deliberative contexts in which an agent explicitly considers whether to believe a given proposition. In such contexts, only evidential (truth-relevant) considerations can influence belief-formation. In contexts in which a subject forms a belief without passing through a deliberative process, on the contrary, non-evidential considerations could influence the belief-formation.

According to Shah, only a normative interpretation of the aim of belief can explain these facts—doxastic transparency, why this phenomenon is specific to doxastic deliberation, and the exclusive role of evidential considerations in deliberative contexts. The explanation is the following: let us assume that it is constitutive of the concept of belief that a belief is correct if and only if it is true. This is interpreted as the claim that someone believing a proposition p is under a normative commitment to believe p only if it is true. When a subject engages in doxastic deliberation and asks herself whether to believe a given proposition, she deploys the concept of belief. Assuming she understands this concept and is aware of its application conditions, she interprets this question as whether to form a mental attitude that she should have only if the proposition is true. This in turn determines a disposition to be moved only by considerations relevant to the truth of p. This explains transparency and the exclusive role of evidential considerations in deliberative contexts. In contrast, in non-deliberative contexts where belief-formation works at a sub-intentional level, the subject does not explicitly consider the question whether to believe p, does not deploy the concept of belief, and is not thereby motivated by the norm to regard only truth-relevant considerations as relevant in the process of belief-formation. For this reason, non-evidential factors can influence belief-formation in these contexts. In sum, Shah’s normativist account allows him to explain both the strong role of truth in the belief regulation in deliberative contexts, and its weak role in non-deliberative ones.

An objection to Shah’s argument is that it assumes an implausibly strong form of motivational internalism according to which the norm of belief necessarily and immediately motivates the agent when she recognizes and accepts it. This contrasts with the ways in which, in general, norms tend to motivate agents (McHugh, 2013; Steglich-Petersen, 2006).

Another argument for a normativist account of truth-directedness, suggested by Wedgwood (2002), is composed of two steps. First, it is argued that the correctness standard of belief expresses a relation of strong supervenience (correctness of a belief strongly supervenes on the truth of that belief’s content). The standard thereby articulates a necessary feature of belief: necessarily, all true beliefs are correct and all false beliefs are incorrect. Second, since the standard articulates a necessary feature of belief, it is an essential feature of beliefs. Both steps of the argument have been criticized (for example, Steglich-Petersen, 2008, pp. 277-278). Against the second step, one cannot infer from a thing necessarily possessing a certain property to the property being essential to the thing it is a property of—using a well-known example of Fine (1994, pp. 4-5), one cannot infer from the necessary claim that Socrates is the only member of the singleton having as its only member Socrates to the claim that it is essential to Socrates that he is the only member of that singleton. Against the first step, it has been argued that it relies on contentious assumptions about normative supervenience: it is an error to deduce from the supervenience of a normative property N over a non-normative property G the necessity of the claim that every object having property G also has property N. The most one can conclude is that, necessarily, if some object has property N in virtue of having property G, then anything with property G also has property N (where necessity here takes a wide scope on the conditional). For similar considerations on normative relations of supervenience, see Blackburn (1993, p. 132); and Steglich-Petersen (2008).

Other arguments often used in support of the normativist interpretation do not clearly favor this interpretation over alternative substantive conceptions of truth-directedness, such as teleological ones. For example, it has been argued that unless one assumes that belief is constitutively governed by a truth-norm, one is not in a position to distinguish beliefs from other cognitive propositional attitudes, such as assuming, thinking, or imagining. The assumption that belief is constitutively governed by a truth-norm has also been used in arguments to the best explanation of a number of features of belief such as (1) the infelicity of asserting Moorean sentences; (2) the disposition to rely on a believed proposition as a reason for action and a premise in practical reasoning (Baldwin, 2007, p. 83); and (3) the relation between belief, assertion, evidence, and action (Griffiths, 1962). See §1.c for discussion of some of these arguments. These various arguments have received formulations both in normativist and teleological terms (for teleological formulations, simply replace occurrences of “truth-norm” with “truth-aim”); for this reason, they do not favor either interpretation. It is also worth mentioning that the claim that belief is constitutively normative has received indirect support from views that, for independent reasons, hold that intentional attitudes in general are constitutively normative (Brandom, 1994; Millar, 2004; Wedgwood, 2007).

Though the normativist interpretation has been the most popular in the last two decades, it has also been the target of several criticisms. According to the No Guidance Argument, a truth-norm is incapable of guiding an agent in the formation and revision of her beliefs. One can conform one’s beliefs to a norm requiring one to believe only true propositions only by first forming beliefs about whether these propositions are true. The only way to follow this norm will thus be continuing to believe what one already believes. Such a norm would not provide any guidance as to what a subject should do in order to comply with it. More precisely, this norm would have no guiding role in processes of belief regulation (formation, maintenance, and revision). Versions of this argument have been given by Glüer & Wikforss (2009, pp. 44-45); Horwich (2006, p. 354); and Mayo (1963, p. 141). A reply to this argument consists in arguing that even if the truth-norm does not provide any direct guidance, it can guide belief regulation indirectly, via some other derived principle like norms of evidence and rationality (Boghossian, 2003; Wedgwood, 2002); or it could guide in specific contexts, such as in doxastic deliberation where an agent explicitly considers her evidence for a given proposition p with the aim of making up her mind about whether p (Shah & Velleman, 2005). For a further defense of the argument see Glüer & Wikforss (2010b, 2013).

Another criticism of the normative interpretation is that, in general, an agent subject to a norm should have some form of intentional control over the actions necessary to satisfy it and be free to choose whether to conform to the norm or not. These conditions on control and freedom to comply seem to be constraints on norms in general. However, belief formation is (at least often) an involuntary process and is realized at an automatic, non-inferential level. It is thus unclear how a truth-norm governing belief can satisfy the above constraints. For versions of this objection, see Glüer & Wikforss (2009); and Steglich-Petersen (2006).

Another problem for normative interpretations of truth-directedness concerns the formulation of the alleged norm of belief. If beliefs are constitutively governed by a truth-norm, it should be possible to state this norm in terms of some duty, prescription, or permission. However, all the suggested formulations seem to be affected by some problem. Bykvist and Hattiangadi (2007), in particular, consider several possible formulations of the norm and conclude that none of them is free from problems. The best known formulations are the following:

(1) For any S, p: S ought to (believe that p) iff p

(2) For any S, p: if S ought to (believe that p), then p

(3) For any S, p: S ought to (believe that p iff p)

All these formulations are flawed in some way. (1) implies that one ought to believe every true proposition, included trivial and uninteresting ones (see also Sosa, 2003 for a similar point). Furthermore, provided there are true propositions that it is impossible to believe (for example, it is raining and nobody believes that it is raining), (1) violates the commonly accepted rule according to which “ought” implies “can.” (2) seems not to be normatively interesting because it is unable to place any requirement on believers—if p is true, nothing follows from it about what S ought to believe; and if p is false, it only follows that it is not the case that S ought to believe that p; it does not follow that S ought not to believe that p. (3) is problematic for it does not allow one to derive claims about what one ought or ought not to believe. For example, from (3) and the falsity of p, one cannot derive that one ought not to believe p. Furthermore, (3) seems to be subject to the same objections raised against (1).

Bykvist and Hattiangadi raise similar objections to other formulations of the truth-norm. From this, they conclude that this general failure could be considered a clue that belief is not at all a normative concept, at least not in the way suggested by normativists. Many have considered this conclusion too hasty. First, even if all the available formulations of the norm are wrong, this does not mean that it is impossible to formulate the norm of belief in “ought” terms; it could simply mean that the right formulation is yet to come. Second, some have suggested alternative formulations that seem to avoid the above problems. For example, Whiting (2010) has suggested that interpreting the truth-norm as a norm of permissibility could avoid most of the problems. Other formulations avoiding these problems have been suggested by Littlejohn (2010), Fassio (2011), and Raleigh (2013). For a discussion, see Bykvist and Hattiangadi (2013). A third way of avoiding these objections is to deny that the norm of belief is a truth-norm (see §3).

A reply to the various considered objections to normative interpretations consists in abandoning a deontic conception of the truth-norm, according to which the norm would be like a prescription, directive, or permission. Adopting alternative non-deontic interpretations of the norm would allow one to avoid the various objections considered above. Some have suggested interpreting the normativity of belief in evaluative terms; that is, in terms of what it is good (in a certain sense of “good” to be specified) to believe (Fassio, 2011; McHugh, 2012b). Others have interpreted the norm of belief as involving a type of normativity sui generis (McHugh, 2014; Rosen, 2001, p. 621), as an ideal of reason (Engel, 2013), or as an “ought to be” in the Sellarsian sense, not requiring addressees of the norm to be capable of voluntarily following it (Chrisman, 2008).

For other criticisms of normativist interpretations of truth-directedness, see also Davidson (2001); Dretske (2000); Horwich (2006, 2013); and Papineau (1999, 2013). The common factor in these criticisms is the defense of the thesis that if there are norms governing beliefs, these are practical, contingent, and not constitutive of belief. Replies to some of the above objections are in Engel (2007, 2013); Shah & Velleman (2005); and Wedgwood (2013).

c. Minimalist Interpretations

The label “minimalist interpretations” is used here for a range of different views. The common factor of these views is that they deny that there is such a property as a truth-aim of belief, at least if one identifies it with some feature different from those considered in §1.b. Minimalists hold that the features supposedly explained by the aim of belief (see §1.c) can be explained by other properties commonly ascribed to these mental states, such as their causal, dispositional, functional, or motivational roles, or their direction of fit (Davidson, 2001; Dretske, 2000; Papineau, 1999).

Given the present characterization, one may wonder whether there is a clear-cut dividing line between teleological and minimalist views; in particular, between sub-intentional teleological views, identifying the aim at truth with functional mechanisms of the cognitive system, and dispositionalist and functionalist minimalist accounts. A way of distinguishing these two approaches is by looking at the dispositional or functional role distinctive of belief (compare McHugh, 2012a, fn. 6): while functionalist accounts congenial to teleological approaches to the truth-aim focus on the input side of belief’s functional role, and exclusively identify this role with a truth-directed goal (for example, forming true beliefs), minimalists think that the role that individuates belief is at least partially on the output side, and they are mainly concerned with practical roles of belief, such as satisfying the subject’s desires or providing reasons for action.

Some philosophers have endorsed accounts of belief according to which causal, dispositional, and/or functional roles of beliefs with respect to action and behavior would be sufficient to characterize and individuate this type of mental attitude. Some have argued that the specific relation between belief and truth can be fully explained by the functional role of beliefs of providing reasons for action. Others have argued that all that is necessary for an attitude to qualify as a belief is that it dispose the subject to behave in ways that would promote the satisfaction of his desires if its content were true. For similar views see, for example, Stalnaker (1984). Armstrong (1973) argues that an essential function of beliefs is moving a subject to action given the presence of suitable dominant desires and purposes, and locates in this causal role the peculiar difference between belief and other mental attitudes such as mere thoughts. Still others have identified the aim at truth of belief with its direction of fit (Humberstone, 1992; Platts, 1979).

A “deflationary” interpretation of truth-directedness has been defended by Vahid (2006, 2009). Vahid first considers the feature of accepting-as-true, introduced by Velleman (2000a), as common to all cognitive states (beliefs, assumptions, conjectures, imaginations…). He suggests that to capture the truth-directedness of belief, one should not add any further (teleological or normative) property to the fact that belief is an attitude of regarding-as-true. Rather, what is distinctive of belief according to Vahid is the specific way in which one regards-as-true a given proposition. While other attitudes involve regarding a proposition as true for the sake of something else, in order to reach certain specific goals (for example, assuming is regarding-as-true for the sake of argument, imagining involves regarding a proposition as true for motivational purposes), believing is regarding a proposition as true for its own sake, as an end in itself.

The main criticism directed at minimalist interpretations is that other mental states such as suppositions and assumptions possess these same properties (same causal, functional, dispositional, and motivational roles; same direction of fit) and, thus, that these properties are not sufficient alone to individuate the peculiar truth-directedness of belief, to explain the special features of belief listed in §1.c, and to distinguish beliefs from other types of mental attitude (Engel, 2004; Velleman, 2000a). For a reply, see, for instance, Zalabardo (2010, §10), who challenges the claim that a purely motivational conception of belief would not be sufficient to distinguish beliefs from other mental attitudes. See also Glüer & Wikforss (2009, p. 42).

3. What Does Belief Aim At?

There is debate concerning whether the aim of belief is truth, as has been traditionally argued, or some other property. Since the late 1990s, an increasing number of philosophers have defended the claim that knowledge is the fundamental aim or norm of belief. Upholders of this view are, among others, Adler (2002); Bird (2007); Huemer (2007); Littlejohn (2013); Peacocke (1999); Sutton (2007); and Williamson (2000). The best known defender of the thesis that belief would aim at knowledge is Williamson (2000). Williamson’s main motivations to hold this thesis derive from his view about the nature of knowledge and its relation to belief. Williamson criticizes the idea that it is possible to provide an analysis of knowledge in terms of other more fundamental notions. Rather, other epistemic notions such as belief and justification should be understood as derivative from the more fundamental notion of knowledge—this is the so-called Knowledge First approach in epistemology. In particular, Williamson suggests that belief be considered roughly as the attitude of treating a proposition as if one knew it. Knowledge would thus fix the standard of appropriateness or the success condition for a belief, and merely believing p without knowing it would be a sort of “botched knowing.” (2000, p. 47). In this sense, belief would not aim merely at truth but at knowledge.

A well-known argument for the knowledge aim is based on a parallel between assertion and belief. On the one side, many have argued that assertion is constitutively governed by a knowledge norm (Adler, 2002; Bird, 2007; Sutton, 2007; Williamson, 2000):

(KNA) one should assert p only if one knows p.

On the other hand, some philosophers have suggested that occurrent belief is the inner analogue of assertion (for example, Williamson, 2000, pp. 255-256). More precisely, the idea is that (flat-out) assertion is the verbal counterpart of a judgment, and a judgment is a form of occurrent (outright) belief. If so, it is plausible that assertion and belief are governed by the same norm, and knowledge would be the norm of belief too:

(KNB) one should believe p only if one knows p.

Similar arguments have been suggested by Adler (2002); Bird (2007); McHugh (2011); Sosa (2010, p. 48); Sutton (2007); and Williamson (2000). To this line of argument, it may be objected that knowledge is not the norm of assertion. Some philosophers have suggested counterexamples to this thesis (Brown 2008; Lackey 2007). Others have argued that assertion is governed by other norms such as truth or justification (Douven, 2006; Weiner, 2005). Another way to criticize this argument consists in challenging the similarity between belief and assertion, arguing in particular that they would not be governed by the same norms. Whiting (2013, pp. 187-188) provides some reasons why one should expect standards of belief and assertion to diverge: since assertion is an “external” act, involving a social dimension, in evaluating an assertion one might have to take into account the expectations and needs of interlocutors and the role of speech acts in the unfolding conversation. Furthermore, assertion is a potential source of testimony. In asserting, one takes on responsibility for others’ beliefs. All these considerations are extraneous to belief, which is a “private” state of mind. It would thus not be surprising if assertions were governed by more demanding epistemic standards than belief due to their social character and their communicative role. Brown (2012, pp. 137-144) provides another argument against the claim that assertion and belief share the same epistemic standard: she first argues that whether an assertion or belief is epistemically appropriate partially depends on its consequences (for example, the epistemic propriety of asserting varies with the stakes), and second, that the consequences of asserting p may differ from those of believing p. It follows that there can be cases in which it is epistemically appropriate for a subject to believe that p, but not to assert that p, and vice versa.

Considerations about versions of Moore’s paradox with “know” in place of “belief” provide another argument for the claim that knowledge is the aim or norm of belief (Adler, 2002; Gibbons, 2013; Huemer, 2007; Sutton, 2007). As it sounds absurd or infelicitous to assert sentences like “it is raining but I do not know it is raining,” it seems incoherent to believe that it is raining and at the same time that one does not know that it is raining. An explanation of this fact could be that knowledge is the aim or norm of belief. A subject believing that it is raining but that she does not know it would violate (KNB). This type of argument has been the target of two objections: first, some have argued that a weaker standard, like a truth-norm, would be sufficient to explain the absurdity of this sort of Moorean belief (see, for example, the explanation considered in §1.c). Second, it has been argued that while asserting Moorean propositions of the form “it is raining but I do not know it is raining” sounds absurd, there is no such absurdity in believing these same propositions. It seems both reasonable and appropriate to believe something even while believing not to know it (McGlynn, 2013; Whiting, 2013, pp. 188-189). Using an example in McGlynn (2013, p. 387), there is nothing unreasonable or incongruous for Jane to believe that her ticket will lose, that this belief is justified, and that nonetheless this belief fails to count as knowledge. A reply to the latter criticism consists in distinguishing between outright (or full) belief and partial belief. Only outright belief would be subject to a knowledge norm. For a reply, see McGlynn (2013, §3) and Whiting (2013, p. 189).

Another argument for the knowledge aim/norm of belief is provided by the way in which we tend to assess (justify and criticize) our beliefs. Williamson (2005, p. 109) provides the following case: John is at the zoo and sees what appears to him to be a zebra in a cage. The animal in the cage is really a zebra. However, unbeknownst to John, to save money, most of the other animals in the zoo have been replaced by cleverly disguised farm animals. In this scenario, John’s belief is true and fully reasonable (after all, he has no reason to believe that the animal in the cage could not be a zebra). Still, John does not know it is a zebra. Intuitively, John needs an excuse for believing that the animal is a zebra. He can excuse himself by pointing out that he is in no position to distinguish his state from one of knowing. The need for an excuse indicates that it is wrong for John to believe that the animal is a zebra. Despite the fact that John’s belief is both reasonable and true, it is somewhat defective. This contrasts with knowing that it is a zebra, which provides a full justification for believing it, not a mere excuse. A reply to this argument is that John is not wrong in believing that the animal is a zebra (and thus does not need an excuse for this). Rather, if John stands in need of correction, this is due to the false background beliefs he has—for example, the belief that animals in this area are all zebras (Littlejohn, 2010; Whiting, 2013).

Some philosophers have argued that knowledge is the aim or norm of belief on the ground that knowledge has more value than mere true belief (Bird, 2007). However, on the one hand, there is no general agreement on whether knowledge is more valuable than true belief. On the other hand, from the fact that knowledge is more valuable than true belief, it does not follow that belief is governed by a norm or involves a constitutive aim at knowledge.

For other arguments in support of the claim that the aim or norm of belief is knowledge, see Bird (2007); Engel (2004); McHugh (2011); and Sutton (2007). For other criticisms of the claim, see Littlejohn (2010); McGlynn (2013); and Whiting (2013).

Though truth and knowledge are widely identified as the main candidates for being the aim or norm of belief, some philosophers have suggested other properties. Another available option is that the aim of belief is reasonability or justification. For a defense of the claim that non-factive justification is the condition of epistemic success for belief, see, for example, Feldman (2002, pp. 378-379). It should be noted that this view has not found many proponents in the 21^st century literature, at least if we exclude philosophers for whom justified belief is factive or requires knowledge (for example, Gibbons, 2013; Littlejohn, 2012; Sutton, 2007). An original approach is that of Smithies (2012), who argues that the fundamental norm of belief is that one be in a position to know what one believes, where “[o]ne is in a position to know a proposition just in case one satisfies all the epistemic, as opposed to psychological, conditions for knowledge, such as having ungettiered justification to believe a true proposition.” (2012, p. 4)

Some philosophers have identified the aim of belief with some specific kind of epistemic virtue one could manifest in the possession of belief (Zagzebski, 2004) or with understanding (Kvanvig, 2003). According to other philosophers, the fundamental aim of belief consists in the satisfaction of practical goals such as survival, utility, or the satisfaction of desires and wants. Similar views are particularly popular among philosophers favoring naturalistic approaches in the philosophy of mind. For example, Millikan (1984) argues that beliefs are integrated in a naturally selected cognitive system having the function of tracking features of the world in order to help in the satisfaction of biological needs such as survival and reproduction. A similar view has been more or less explicitly endorsed by, for example, Horwich (2006); Kornblith (1993); and Papineau (1999, 2013).

Another option is that belief possesses multiple aims or norms equally fundamental and irreducible to each other. For example, Weiner (2014) endorses pluralism about epistemic norms, arguing that there are many different epistemic norms, each valid from a different standpoint, and that no one of these standpoints need be better than another. In a virtue-theoretic framework, Wright (2014) argues that there are two fundamental epistemic aims: believing in accordance with the intellectual virtues (such as intellectual courage, carefulness, and open-mindedness), and believing the truth and avoiding falsehoods.

4. Relevance of the Topic

The topic discussed in the present article has relevance for several more general philosophical debates. It is clearly relevant in those areas of philosophy directly concerned with the notion of belief, such as the Philosophy of Mind, and in particular, the ontology of mental attitudes. One of the issues that traditionally have most concerned philosophers is that of individuating the distinctive feature of belief with respect to other mental attitudes such as trusting, mere thinking, imagining, guessing, and so on. As David Hume admits (1739, book I, part III, §7), the distinction between belief and mere thought was the first philosophical problem that the Scottish philosopher posed himself, and also one of the hardest he found to solve (for a discussion, see Armstrong, 1973, part I, §5). Whereas the difference between belief and other types of mental attitude seems to reside in the specific relationship that belief entertains with truth (or knowledge), it has been extremely difficult to grasp the peculiar nature of such a relationship. The 21^st century debate on the aim of belief promises to provide an answer to such a problem. In answering questions about the nature of the aim (see §2), it also promises to shed some light on the issue of whether belief is a normative attitude or whether it can be characterized by a fully naturalistic account.

The progress in the debate about the aim/norm of belief also substantially contributes to the study of norms and aims of other attitudes such as desires, emotions, and intentions. The aim of such studies is to provide a unified and coherent representation of the various norms and aims of mental attitudes and of their reciprocal relations (for example, Millar, 2009; Railton, 1997; Shah, 2008; Velleman, 2000b; Wedgwood, 2007). For instance, Wedgwood (2007) interprets the aim of attitudes as norms of correctness and argues that similar norms are constitutive and individuative of all intentional attitudes. Similarly, Shah (2008) applies an argument analogous to the transparency argument for belief (considered in §2.b) to other attitudes. In particular, he argues that the hypothesis that the concept of intention is governed by a constitutive norm would best explain the presumed fact that in order to conclude deliberation on whether to intend to A one must answer the question whether to A.

The debate on the aim of belief has, also, a particular relevance for certain views in philosophy of normativity. According to a prominent view in meta-ethics (so-called Constitutivism), normative facts can be grounded in facts about the constitution of action or agency. According to this view, agency is constitutively governed by practical norms (for example, Korsgaard, 1996; Velleman, 2000b). Some philosophers have tried to extend the view to other normative domains such as epistemology and aesthetics. The epistemological analogue of Ethical Constitutivism holds that epistemic normativity can be grounded in the constitutive aim or norm of belief. For a criticism of constitutivist approaches, see Enoch (2006).

The view that epistemic normativity is grounded in a fundamental truth-aim of belief has deep roots in the 20^st century history of epistemology. Many philosophers in the past have argued that there is a strict dependence relation between the fundamental aim or norm of belief (sometimes presented as a conjunction of two values or goals of believing truly and avoiding falsehoods) and other derivable normative epistemic standards such as justification and rationality. Versions of this view have been defended by many well-known epistemologists, including Chisholm, Goldman, Lehrer, Plantinga, Alston, Foley, and Sosa (see Alston, 2005, ch. 1, for an overview). Accounts of this relation differ depending on the notions of justification and rationality adopted by philosophers, and by how philosophers conceive the relation between the truth-aim and other derived normative properties (for example, consequentialist, deontologist, virtue-based…).

Another approach in epistemology concerned with the topic of the aim or norm of belief is the so-called Knowledge First approach introduced in §3. According to this view, knowledge has a prominent role among epistemic notions and constitutes the fundamental epistemic standard of assertion, belief, action, practical reasoning, and disagreement (compare “Knowledge Norms”). This approach has generated a comparative study of these standards (for example, Smithies, 2012). An example is the reformulation of various arguments for the knowledge norm of assertion in order to defend other knowledge norms, such as those of belief and action (compare §3). In this perspective, the debate on the aim of belief can help in understanding important aspects of epistemic norms of assertion, action, practical reasoning, and disagreement, and in turn can receive important contributions from advances in the debates about norms governing these other practices.

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Author Information

Davide Fassio
Email: davide.fassio@unige.ch
University of Geneva
Switzerland