Religious Disagreement

The domain of religious inquiry is characterized by pervasive and seemingly intractable disagreement. Whatever stance one takes on central religious questions—for example, whether God exists, what the nature of God might be, whether the world has a purpose, whether there is life beyond death—one will stand opposed to a large contingent of highly informed and intelligent thinkers. The fact of extensive religious disagreement raises several distinct philosophical questions. One significant question arises within the context of political philosophy: may religious conceptions of the good and the right legitimately ground one’s political convictions in a pluralistic society marked by diverse and often conflicting religious convictions? Other questions concern the possibility of reconciling disagreement data with specific religious beliefs. For example, can persistent religious disagreement be squared with the conviction of many Christians and other theists that God “desires everyone to be saved and to come to knowledge of the truth” (I Timothy 2:4, NRSV)? These and other important questions will not be taken up here. The focus of this article is the epistemic challenge raised by religious disagreement: does awareness of the nature and extent of religious disagreement make it unreasonable to hold confident religious, or explicitly irreligious, views? Many philosophers have answered this question in the affirmative, arguing that the proper response to religious disagreement is religious skepticism. Others contend that religious conviction may be reasonably maintained even in the face of disagreement with highly qualified thinkers.

Reflecting on the epistemic challenge posed by religious disagreement readily leads one to questions concerning the epistemic significance of disagreement in general, religious or otherwise. One might think that religious disagreement does not raise any distinctive epistemological questions beyond those that are addressed in a more general work on disagreement. There are, however, features of religious disagreements that present problems that, for the most part, are not adequately addressed in such a work. These features include the lack of agreement on what skills, virtues, and qualifications are most important for assessing the questions under dispute; the fact that many of the disputed beliefs are arguably epistemically fundamental; the significant evidential weight that is assigned to private experiences; and the prominence of practical or pragmatic considerations in the justifications offered for opposing viewpoints. While these features taken individually may not be exclusive to religious disagreements, the fact that they frequently coincide in religious disputes and are especially salient in such disputes makes religious disagreement a worthy epistemological topic in its own right. The bulk of this article will focus on these problematic features of religious disagreements and the special questions they raise.

The First-Order and Higher-Order Significance of Religious Disagreement
The Conciliatory Argument for the Higher-Order Defeat of Religious Belief
Permissivist Responses to the Conciliatory Argument
Religious Belief and the Problem of Judging Epistemic Credentials
Fundamental Versus Superficial Disagreements
Appeals to Religious Experience
Faith and Practical Responses to the Problem of Religious Disagreement
Conclusion
References and Further Reading

1. The First-Order and Higher-Order Significance of Religious Disagreement

Religious disagreement may present two distinct sorts of evidential challenges to a given religious belief: a first-order challenge and higher-order challenge. (Henceforth, the label “religious belief” will typically be used to refer to all beliefs that take a stand on religious questions, including explicitly irreligious beliefs such as the belief that there is no God.) The aim of this section is to clarify the distinction between first-order and higher-order evidential challenges and to look at examples of how religious disagreement may possess first-order significance for religious belief. The remaining sections will focus on the higher-order challenge posed by religious disagreement.

In the epistemological literature on disagreement, a contrast is frequently drawn between first-order and higher-order evidence (Kelly 2005). The distinction may roughly be characterized as follows. First-order evidence for or against some proposition p “directly” bears on the question of whether p, whereas higher-order evidence for or against p does not directly bear on the question of whether p but directly bears on the question of whether one has rationally assessed the first-order evidence for or against p. To illustrate the distinction, consider the case (from Rotondo 2013) of Detective, who has stayed up all night studying the evidence bearing on a particular crime. At the end of the lengthy process of sifting the evidence, Detective judges that it is very likely that Lefty, rather than Righty, committed the crime. When she calls Lieutenant to share her conclusion, Lieutenant asks whether Detective has stayed up all night and then informs Detective that every time Detective has stayed up all night in the past, her reasoning has been atrocious and unreliable (despite its seeming to Detective that nothing is amiss). Let’s call this fact that Detective has a bad track record after all-nighters UNRELIABLE. According to many epistemologists, upon learning UNRELIABLE, Detective ought to become significantly less confident that Lefty committed the crime. (Still, there are others [Lasonen-Aarnio 2014 and Titelbaum 2015] who argue that Detective should not reduce confidence if she in fact assessed the first-order evidence correctly.) Thus, UNRELIABLE is arguably evidence against Detective’s proposition that Lefty committed the crime. However, UNRELIABLE does not directly bear on the question of whether Lefty committed the crime in the same way that the evidence Detective stayed up examining does. It is not as though UNRELIABLE is more to be expected if Righty committed the crime than if Lefty committed the crime: someone who had a full night’s sleep before examining the evidence inspected by Detective could dismiss UNRELIABLE as evidentially irrelevant. If UNRELIABLE gives Detective reason to doubt the Lefty hypothesis, it is only because UNRELIABLE is higher-order evidence that raises doubts about any conclusion that Detective might have reached after an all-nighter.

Facts about religious disagreement may pose first-order or higher-order evidential worries (or both) for religious belief.

Suppose that religious view R1 suggests a view of human nature where persistent religious disagreement is to be expected, while religious view R2 suggests a view of human nature where persistent religious disagreement would be very surprising (though not impossible). Given this supposition, persistent religious disagreement would constitute first-order evidence in favor of R1 over R2. In addition to this first-order significance of religious disagreement, however, facts about disagreement may constitute higher-order evidence against both religious views if these facts raise worries about the rationality of one’s religious views or the reliability of the process by which one’s religious beliefs have been formed. Alternatively, we can imagine a situation where widespread religious agreement on the truth of R1 provides higher-order support of R1 (by boosting one’s confidence in the general reliability of religious belief formation) even though religious agreement is unexpected given R1, and thus counts as first-order evidence against it. The first-order significance of religious disagreement is thus distinct from its higher-order significance.

An example of an argument in the philosophy of religion that makes claims about the first-order significance of religious disagreement is the argument from divine hiddenness. This argument against theism begins by noting that according to most theists, the highest good for a human being is to be in a loving relationship with God. Many theists also claim that since God loves all human beings, God desires to be in a loving relationship with each human person. If this view is a component of theism, then, given theism, we have reason to expect that God would make God’s existence evident to all—for the lack of belief that God exists is a barrier to the loving relationship that God desires. The fact that many intelligent and thoughtful people fail to believe in God, including many people who indicate they would like to believe in God if it were possible for them to do so, is evidence that God has not made God’s existence very evident, contrary to what theism might lead us to expect. Thus, extensive and pervasive disagreement over whether God exists is claimed to be evidence against theism.

John Hick (2004) offers a very different characterization of the first-order evidential significance of religious disagreement. Rather than suggesting that such disagreement supplies an evidential basis for atheism, Hick suggests that such disagreement can instead be viewed as evidence that genuine encounters with “the Real”—that transcendent reality that is the source of salvation and that is encountered in all of the world’s great religions—are inevitably understood through conceptual frames that prevent unproblematic cognitive access to the Real as it is in itself and lead to diverse, and often conflicting, interpretations of such experiences. This position, which Hick labels “religious pluralism,” is not motivated by intractable religious disagreement alone. Hick emphasizes that the major world religions have all proven to be successful as vehicles that move practitioners from “self-centredness” to “Reality-centredness,” and this ethical parity across multiple faiths is seen by Hick as undermining the basis for thinking that one religious tradition may reasonably claim supremacy in the veridicality of its teaching. However, it is clear that Hick’s pluralism would be unmotivated if it were the case that religious dialogue typically led to an end of religious disagreement and to agreement on the teachings of one religious tradition. Hence, the fact of persistent religious disagreement does play a crucial evidential role in the case for Hick’s pluralistic hypothesis.

The argument for divine hiddenness and the case for religious pluralism can both be understood as appeals to the first-order rather than higher-order significance of religious disagreement. Consider first Hick’s pluralism. Since pluralism is itself a controversial and significantly contested religious viewpoint, the higher-order worries raised by disagreement as discussed below would seem, at least initially, to apply as much to the belief in pluralism as to other religious convictions. Considered as a piece of first-order evidence, however, religious disagreement does lend more support to religious pluralism than to many other religious hypotheses. If culturally-conditioned interpretive frameworks are as entrenched and significant as pluralists contend, then we should expect religious conversion to be fairly rare and religious disagreement to be rather intractable, as is in fact the case. Many non-pluralist religious perspectives will have a harder time accommodating this datum. Similarly, the argument from divine hiddenness is clearly a first-order rather than higher-order challenge to theistic belief. Even if religious disagreement did not pose a higher-order challenge to the theist, the fact of significant and persistent disagreement over theism could still be first-order evidence against theism. For example, even if a theist somehow knew that she and her fellow theists were in possession of more evidence than non-theists, so that the disagreement over theism did not give her any reason for questioning whether or not she and other theists have made some error in their assessment of the evidence, the fact that many reject theism, even if due to lack of information, would still constitute evidence against theism since prevalent disbelief is more to be expected given atheism than theism.

2. The Conciliatory Argument for the Higher-Order Defeat of Religious Belief

We turn now from the first-order significance of religious disagreement to an argument for the claim that religious disagreement constitutes higher-order evidence that renders religious belief (or at least many religious beliefs) unjustified—that is, that religious disagreement constitutes a higher-order defeater for religious belief. The argument for this conclusion can be seen as consisting of two components: one a priori and the other a posteriori. The a priori component aims to defend some general “conciliatory” policy that says that in disagreements that satisfy certain conditions, the proper response is a conciliatory one that gives significant weight to the views of one’s disputants. This conciliatory response might involve giving up one’s belief and adopting an agnostic stance towards the question under dispute. Or, if someone’s doxastic state is better described not in terms of belief or unbelief, but in terms of subjective probabilities or “credences,” then the appropriate conciliatory response might involve adopting a new credence for the disputed proposition that gives significant weight to the initial credences of one’s disputants. The a posteriori component of the argument aims to show that the core commitments of religious believers are in fact subject to the relevant type of disagreement—a disagreement where the aforementioned conciliatory principle requires significant reduction in confidence.

a. Strong Conciliatory Policies

The a priori stage of the argument defends some conciliatory policy that is demanding enough to require significant reduction of confidence in religious disagreements. There is no canonical conciliatory policy that is agreed upon by those who argue that disagreement has significant higher-order force, but a variety of conciliatory requirements have been proposed, some more demanding than others. Despite the diversity of conciliatory proposals, one can discern behind the most demanding conciliatory views two basic commitments (Vavova 2014). The first is a principle that requires epistemic deference to other thinkers in proportion to their apparent epistemic qualifications, and the second is a principle that constrains the types of reasons to which one can legitimately appeal when assessing the relative epistemic qualifications of the various sides of the dispute. It is worth separating these principles out, since some criticisms of the most demanding conciliatory views can be understood as targeting the first principle, while others, the second. We might articulate these principles as follows:

DEFERENCE: In a disagreement over p, one ought to show epistemic deference to suitably qualified thinkers, giving equal weight to one’s own view and the view of an apparent epistemic peer (where an “epistemic peer” is someone whose epistemic credentials with respect to p are equal to one’s own) and more weight to the view of someone who appears to be one’s epistemic superior.

INDEPENDENCE: In assessing my own and my disputant’s epistemic credentials with respect to p, in order to determine how (or whether) to modify my own belief about p, I should base my assessment on grounds that are independent of my disputed reasoning concerning p. (Adapted from Christensen 2011.)

Consider DEFERENCE first. The basic idea behind DEFERENCE is that one cannot reasonably maintain confident belief that p while thinking that those who reject p are just as qualified and well-positioned to assess the plausibility of p as those on one’s own side of the dispute. For example, according to DEFERENCE, someone who believes that Muhammad is a prophet of God cannot reasonably think that those who reject this claim are, taken as a whole, just as qualified to assess the claim as those who accept it. Whether DEFERENCE is plausible partly depends on what is meant by “epistemic credentials.” The principle is plausible only if our understanding of epistemic credentials is such that we should expect those who are more credentialed to be more reliable in their views on the disputed question than those who are less credentialed. This means that epistemic credentials must be assessed relative to the particular proposition under dispute and the particular occasion when the proposition was assessed. Furthermore, the relevant credentials must take into account all of the dimensions of epistemic evaluation that bear on the reliability of one’s judgment on the matter at hand, such as the quality and quantity of one’s evidence and the ability to assess that evidence in a rational and unbiased manner. This understanding of epistemic credentials may not align with conventional notions of expertise. For example, someone who is a leading researcher on a contested scientific question might count as less credentialed than a well-informed non-specialist if there is concern that the researcher’s personal involvement has biased her judgment.

Given a sufficiently fine-grained understanding of epistemic credentials, DEFERENCE looks very plausible. Those who reject DEFERENCE must affirm that there are situations where I can reasonably stand by my view that p even though I acknowledge that my epistemic position with respect to p is no stronger than that enjoyed by my interlocutor who denies p. It seems that in such a situation, I would need to hold that, despite our equally strong epistemic positions, I was simply lucky in arriving at the truth and my interlocutor was not. Many writing on disagreement seem to take it for granted that this would not be a rational position. Even those who oppose demanding conciliatory views typically hold that in order to dismiss the worries raised by disagreement, it is necessary to identify a “symmetry breaker” (Lackey 2010), or some reason for thinking that one’s own side is better placed to assess the disputed matter than the opposition. In the next section, we consider one response to disagreement-motivated religious skepticism that involves rejecting DEFERENCE.

INDEPENDENCE is the more controversial of the two conciliatory principles offered above. Christensen (2009), who is responsible for labeling the principle, argues that INDEPENDENCE is the key principle separating “conciliationists” and their opponents. According to Christensen, INDEPENDENCE captures what is wrong with “blatantly question-begging” responses to disagreement (2011). He gives an example where two individuals who are sharing a dinner at a restaurant with several friends both calculate in their head what each person’s share of the total bill comes to (Christensen 2007). They agree to add 20% of the post-tax total for tip and to split the check evenly among each member of the party. Both friends do this sort of calculation often and know that the other person is no more or less reliable than they are. They usually agree on the answer in such cases, but in those instances when they do reach different answers, neither of them has proven more likely than the other to be the one who has made an error. While nothing is out of the ordinary in this case (for example, neither friend is especially distracted or extra alert), upon finishing their mental calculations they discover that their answers differ: one arrived at an answer of $43, and the other, $45. According to Christensen (2011), INDEPENDENCE is needed to explain why it would be illegitimate for one of the two friends to dismiss the significance of the disagreement by reasoning as follows: “Since my friend fails to see that the facts support an answer of $43, I have good reason for thinking that, contrary to my expectations, she is not (at least at this moment) a reliable judge of the question we are disputing; therefore, her disagreement gives me no reason at all to question my answer.”

Most agree that this sort of response to the disagreement is unreasonably sanguine. But it is questionable whether a principle as strong as INDEPENDENCE is needed to explain why this response is unreasonable (Kelly 2013). Note that in the present example, the speaker did not have any reason to be dismissive of his friend’s view antecedent to learning that she arrived at a different answer. His only reason for judging that she was unreliable was the fact that her answer differed from his. Such crudely dogmatic reasoning, if acceptable, could be used to dismiss as misleading any piece of evidence that goes against what one believes. This is quite different from a situation where someone’s belief that p gives him a reason for thinking, even before learning what his friend thinks about p, that his friend is unlikely to be reliable in her judgment concerning p. Consider, for instance, a situation where someone comes to believe in a religion that teaches that the wealthy are frequently biased when it comes to assessing spiritual questions. Such a person has a reason for distrusting his wealthy friend’s opinion concerning the religion even before learning what her opinion is. Suppose the new convert learns that his wealthy friend does reject the new religion as false, but the convert is largely unworried by the disagreement since his new religion teaches that the wealthy are biased on such matters. While this dismissal appeals to dispute-dependent reasons and thus violates INDEPENDENCE, the dismissal would not be based on the crude sort of dogmatic reasoning that would always be available in any dispute. It is at least less obvious in this case that the dispute-dependent reasoning is objectionable. This provides some reason for doubting whether a strong anti-question-begging principle like INDEPENDENCE is needed in order to explain why the quick dismissal in the calculation case is problematic.

b. Modest Conciliatory Policies

The last section focused on the most demanding sort of conciliatory policy, which features both DEFERENCE and INDEPENDENCE. But many proponents of broadly conciliatory views advocate less demanding policies that feature weaker principles than these. In particular, many seek to avoid some of the radical implications that are thought to follow from INDEPENDENCE, opting instead for a weaker anti-question-begging constraint. To see why INDEPENDENCE taken as a general requirement is thought to support implausibly demanding prescriptions, suppose you find yourself in a disagreement with a radical skeptic who believes that human cognitive faculties, including those employed in philosophical reasoning, are systematically unreliable. You might have many reasons for thinking that this skeptic is not particularly qualified with respect to philosophical matters. Perhaps he has not read any academic philosophy and succumbs to several logical fallacies in his argumentation. Still, these reasons for putting little trust in your interlocutor would not be dispute-independent, since you should not trust your ability to judge epistemic credentials if you took seriously the skeptic’s view that your cognitive faculties are systematically unreliable. It would seem, then, that in this context, you cannot have dispute-independent reasons for thinking that you are more qualified than your disputant. Of course, you also cannot have dispute-independent reasons for thinking that your disputant is more qualified. Nonetheless, a lack of dispute-independent reasons for favoring either side may itself be considered a dispute-independent reason for having an equal estimation of the epistemic credentials of the two sides. If this is right, then INDEPENDENCE, in combination with DEFERENCE, would seem to require that you give up believing in the reliability of your cognitive faculties. Since most do not think that we must have non-question-begging reasons for rejecting skepticism, even when we encounter a real skeptic, many advocates of conciliatory views aim to articulate an anti-question-begging constraint that is less absolute than INDEPENDENCE. Conciliatory views that feature a weaker anti-question-begging requirement may nonetheless be sufficiently powerful to undermine religious beliefs.

One example of a weaker anti-question-begging requirement is that proposed by Schellenberg (2007, 171). Schellenberg allows that the need to avoid the most general skepticism warrants trusting those belief-forming mechanisms that are (nearly) universal and unavoidable, even when there are no non-question-begging reasons for such trust. This would explain why we need not capitulate in disagreements with an isolated skeptic who doubts the reliability of our perceptual, memorial, and/or inferential faculties. According to Schellenberg, however, a mechanism that is neither universal nor unavoidable should not be trusted in the absence of independent grounds for thinking that it is reliable. Since he maintains that religious belief-formation is neither universal nor unavoidable, and since it is not possible in the current context of religious controversy to give non-question-begging grounds for taking some particular mechanism of religious belief formation to be reliable, Schellenberg concludes that religious skepticism is the only rational option.

Alston (1991, 198-9) has contested the claim that non-universal belief-forming mechanisms should be held to higher epistemic standards than universal mechanisms, claiming that there is no reason to suppose that all mechanisms worthy of default trust will be common to all or most mature adults. Additionally, Schellenberg’s criteria appear to have consequences that many would find dubious.

Consider the example (adapted from Plantinga [2000, 450]) of someone in colonial America who is strongly inclined towards the view that chattel slavery is morally abhorrent, but who is not unavoidably drawn to this conclusion. Schellenberg’s criteria seem to imply that such a person cannot rationally judge slavery to be morally abhorrent unless she can cite dispute-independent reasons for thinking her own moral views are more likely to be reliable than the majority position. This is an unpalatable conclusion, since it is questionable whether such dispute-independent reasons could be identified.

Another attempt to articulate a more qualified constraint on question-begging is that supplied by Christensen (2011). Christensen acknowledges that in a dispute with a radical skeptic (or with someone else who questions all of the beliefs we rely on to assess epistemic credentials), we lack a dispute-independent reason for thinking that we are more qualified than our disputant. Nevertheless, he argues that the mere absence of dispute-independent reasons for favoring one’s own side is not enough for disagreement to pose legitimate skeptical worries. Nor will disagreements pose serious skeptical worries in cases where a dispute-independent evaluation produces only a very weak reason for thinking that the credentials of one’s disputant rival or surpass one’s own. On the contrary, significant conciliation will typically be required only when there are sufficiently strong positive dispute-independent grounds for trusting the other side. Christensen’s bill tabulation case, where the disagreeing friends have significant track record data that suggest that they are equally reliable at mental math, is an example where the disputants have strong dispute-independent reasons for taking the other person to be an epistemic peer, resulting in significant conciliatory pressure. In contrast, consider a disagreement between two philosophers who systematically disagree across a wide range of ethical questions. While these philosophers might acknowledge that they are both comparable in intelligence, degree of philosophical training, and general intellectual virtue, this sort of parity provides a much weaker reason (in comparison to the solid track record data of the first case) for thinking that the other person is an approximate peer. Christensen’s view would therefore suggest that the conciliatory pressure is weaker in this latter case. The significance of Christensen’s moderate conciliationism for religious belief is discussed in section 4.

c. The a Posteriori Stage of the Argument

No plausible conciliatory policy will require giving up religious belief in the face of just any disagreement. Plausible policies will require religious skepticism only if one’s religious beliefs are contested by a sufficiently large and qualified contingent of individuals. The full argument that religious disagreement defeats some religious belief must do more than merely assert that the belief is contested; it must assert that the degree of dissent is significant enough that the correct view on disagreement will require abandoning the belief. This is the a posteriori stage of the argument, which has received little attention despite the fact that it is far from trivial. Consider the evidential implications of the distribution of opinion concerning the existence of God. A 2010 poll of over 18,000 adults conducted by Ipsos in 23 countries found that 51% of respondents reported believing in at least one God or “Supreme Being,” 17% reported sometimes believing and sometimes not believing, 13% reported not being sure if they believe, and 18% indicated that they do not believe in any sort of divine being. These percentages vary only slightly across different levels of education. The epistemic import of this data is far from clear. Kelly (2011) suggests that the fact that theistic belief is significantly more prevalent than atheistic belief constitutes evidence that at least slightly supports theism. But some proponents of religious skepticism may argue that the exact proportions are not very significant, and that what is epistemically significant is the lack of consensus. Additionally, many hold that the beliefs in the overall population are far less significant than the beliefs of those with relevant expertise. And atheism is the dominant position in certain communities of experts. For example, a large 2009 survey of professional philosophers conducted by Bourget and Chalmers at 99 leading departments found that 73% of professional philosophers accepted or leaned towards atheism, while only 15% accepted or leaned towards theism. On the other hand, most philosophers specializing in philosophy of religion were theists, with 72% accepting or leaning towards theism and only 19% accepting or leaning towards atheism. Draper and Nichols (2013) argue that the specialists in philosophy of religion are significantly influenced by pro-religious biases, a claim which, if true, would perhaps significantly diminish the epistemic significance of the prominence of theistic belief among philosophers of religion. No doubt some theists would counter that certain selection effects and anti-theistic biases in the wider professional culture of philosophy help to explain the prominence of atheism among philosophers as a whole. In any case, many religious believers would contest the notion that philosophical expertise is the most important qualification for reliably evaluating religious questions (see section 4). Clearly, several delicate and contentious questions must be addressed by anyone attempting to measure the degree of qualified opposition to a given religious perspective.

d. The Scope of the Conciliatory Argument

Some proponents of disagreement-motivated religious skepticism target any confident view on contentious religious questions, including those atheistic perspectives that would not typically be labeled “religious.” Others argue that religious disagreement defeats the justification of explicitly religious worldviews, but do not think that secular atheism is similarly threatened. According to Kitcher (2014, 7), “the religious convictions of many contemporary believers are formed in very much the same ways,” namely, through trusting a religious community that claims to preserve and pass on the teachings of prophets and mystics who had some special connection with God or the transcendent. Since this process leads to incompatible beliefs when it is employed in different cultural contexts, the process is unreliable and cannot justifiably be trusted. Because Kitcher does not think that religious disagreement undermines secular atheism—indeed, he appeals to religious disagreement precisely to motivate a “soft atheism” that makes “small concessions in the direction of agnosticism” (23-4)—he presumably thinks that acceptance of secular atheism is not based on a process of communal trust that is relevantly like the unreliable sort of trust that typically grounds religious conviction. Thus, religious disagreement defeats those beliefs typically labeled “religious,” but does not defeat secular convictions.

A significant problem for this more narrowly targeted defeat argument is that many religious believers will deny that the process by which they hold their convictions is accurately characterized as one of uncritically trusting their religious community. They may acknowledge that unreflective trust of a religious community is unjustified (in light of religious diversity), but insist that the process by which they hold their beliefs is one of critically reflecting on all of the evidence. This evidence includes their personal experience and community’s experience, to be sure, but also testimonial evidence from other communities, scientific evidence, and philosophical considerations. Kitcher anticipates a response along these lines, but insists that even when we confine our focus to reflective and philosophically sophisticated religious believers, we still find a substantial amount of controversy, and for this reason he thinks that even philosophically reflective religious belief is defeated by disagreement (9-10). What is unclear, however, is why Kitcher thinks that an irreligious secular outlook can avoid epistemic defeat when the process that presumably accounts for his secular convictions—namely, the process of critical philosophical examination of all the relevant evidence—is a process that appears to lead many thinkers to conclusions that are incompatible with his secularism. If one insists that religious disagreement defeats even reflective religious belief, it will be difficult to maintain that explicitly irreligious belief is not similarly threatened (Bogardus 2013a, 390).

3. Permissivist Responses to the Conciliatory Argument

As discussed in the last section, the conciliatory views that lie behind arguments for disagreement-based religious skepticism can often be understood as consisting of two commitments: a commitment to a principle like DEFERENCE that requires epistemic deference to apparently qualified interlocutors, and a commitment to a principle like INDEPENDENCE that prohibits a question-begging assessment of epistemic qualifications. While many responses to arguments for disagreement-based religious skepticism take issue with INDEPENDENCE, some target DEFERENCE. These responses are the focus of this section.

Critics of DEFERENCE maintain that its plausibility depends on an unacceptably restrictive conception of rationality according to which a given body of evidence rationalizes at most one doxastic attitude towards any given proposition (Schoenfield 2014). On this restrictive picture, if two agents A and B have exactly the same evidence bearing on p and are both perfectly rational in responding to that evidence, then A and B will have the same view on p’s plausibility. This thesis is frequently called the “uniqueness thesis” (Feldman 2007), since it holds that there is a uniquely rational doxastic response to any particular body of evidence. Critics of DEFERENCE deny uniqueness and maintain that, in at least some contexts, there is no single response to a given body of evidence that is maximally rational. Religious questions are often cited as one context where rationality is “permissive” in this way. Surely, these “permissivists” maintain, there is no single credence for, say, God’s existence that stands alone as the maximally rational response to a given body of evidence.

The permissivist objection to the applicability of DEFERENCE in religious disputes thus consists of two claims: (i) DEFERENCE applies in contexts of religious disagreement only if such contexts are rationally impermissive (such that there is a unique doxastic response that is fully rational); and (ii) many religious disagreements are contexts where rationality is permissive.

Here is one way of motivating the first claim. Suppose that Al knows that Beth possesses more or less the same evidence as him concerning religious matters and that she is epistemically impeccable. Presumably, the discovery that Beth rejects Al’s religious views should lead Al to worry about his religious views only if this discovery gives Al reason to suspect that his view is not a fully rational response to his (pre-disagreement) evidence. Furthermore, Beth’s contrary religious viewpoint gives Al a good reason to suspect such irrationality only if it cannot be the case that there are multiple contrary religious viewpoints that are each a fully rational response to their evidence. In other words, the disagreement gives Al a good reason to question the rationality of his initial view only if their religious dispute is a context where rationality is impermissive. If full rationality permits a variety of religious perspectives in response to the same evidence, then religious disagreement does not raise worries about the rationality of one’s pre-disagreement religious views and the epistemic deference commended by DEFERENCE would seem to be unmotivated.

It is controversial whether DEFERENCE depends for its motivation on a non-permissivist conception of rationality as the above argument maintains. While advocates of conciliatory views do frequently characterize the worry raised by disagreement as a worry about the rationality of one’s pre-disagreement position, this need not be the only concern raised by disagreement (Christensen 2014). Even if Al knew that his religious reasoning is perfectly rational, Beth’s disagreement could still raise a different sort of worry: Beth’s disagreement might constitute evidence that rational reflection on religious questions does not reliably lead to true religious beliefs. And the knowledge that the rational formation of one’s religious views does not reliably conduce to true belief arguably gives Al a defeater for his religious views, even if Al knows that, prior to learning of the disagreement, his views were fully rational. Of course, if almost all rational people agreed with Al and only a few with Beth, Al might be able to affirm that rational reflection on religious matters does reliably lead to the truth, and perhaps he could be untroubled by the fact that in Beth and a few others, genuinely rational reflection has led to false religious views. (Beth, being in the small minority, could not be similarly sanguine.) But if the number of apparently rational thinkers who are as informed as Al and yet disagree with him rivals the number who agree with him, then religious disagreement would supply evidence of the unreliability of rational religious reflection and may on that account defeat confident religious belief.

Supposing that DEFERENCE does depend on a non-permissive conception of rationality, despite the preceding reflections, is it plausible to maintain that rationality is permissive with respect to many religious questions? It seems fairly clear that there are contexts where rationality is not permissive. For example, someone’s credence that they will win a particular lottery ought to conform to the mathematical odds (absent any reason to suspect supernatural intervention or corrupt lottery officials). But many philosophers find it implausible to suppose that the requirements of rationality are equally precise in domains of inquiry like religion. The types of evidence and rational standards that govern views on the reality of an afterlife, for example, seem too coarse-grained to admit of a precise credence that is maximally rational, or even a maximally rational credence range with precise endpoints. (For a vigorous defense of the uniqueness thesis, see White [2005].) Also, even if we are concerned not with credences but with the coarse-grained doxastic attitudes of belief, disbelief, and withholding (neither believing nor disbelieving), it seems implausible to suppose that there are no borderline cases where either of two attitudes (for example, belief or withholding) could be fully rational.

Even if there are good reasons for thinking that rationality is permissive in religious contexts, it is not clear that an appeal to permissive rationality can defuse worries raised by religious disagreement. First, the affirmation that rationality permits fundamentally opposed religious perspectives appears to be incompatible with certain religious perspectives. The apostle Paul, for instance, asserts that creation provides evidence of God’s eternal power and divine nature that is plain to all, and that the wicked who turn away from God “suppress the truth” (Romans 1.18ff). Second, even if permissivism is correct and religiously acceptable, questions may be raised about just how permissive rationality is. Perhaps weak belief in the reality of an afterlife as well as agnosticism on the question could both be fully rational responses to a given body of evidence. But could confident belief as well as confident disbelief in the afterlife both be fully rational responses to a given body of evidence? An extreme permissivist view that answers this question in the affirmative is significantly more controversial than permissivism itself.

Because it is not clear how permissive rationality is, if indeed it is permissive, with respect to religious questions, it is not clear what degree of religious disagreement among those with similar evidence is required to indicate likely irrationality on the part of at least one of the parties to the disagreement. But religious disagreement is notable for being so extreme. Many Christians, for example, are utterly convinced that God raised Jesus from the dead; on the contrary, many atheists think that theism, not to mention Jesus’ resurrection, is fanciful nonsense that can be dismissed out of hand. Perhaps no other domain of inquiry exhibits this degree of doxastic polarization. Those who appeal to permissivism in order to defuse worries raised by religious disagreement must therefore affirm a very strong form of permissivism according to which rationality radically underdetermines the appropriate response to a given body of evidence. Even philosophers who are inclined towards permissivism may find such an extreme form of the view unpalatable and implausible.

4. Religious Belief and the Problem of Judging Epistemic Credentials

If DEFERENCE is correct, despite the permissivist challenge just considered, then the religious views of apparent epistemic peers or epistemic superiors on religious matters ought to be accorded significant weight. But how are we to determine who our epistemic peers and superiors are? Asked differently, how are we to assess epistemic credentials? As discussed in section 2, many affirm some principle like INDEPENDENCE and maintain that epistemic credentials ought to be assessed in a dispute-independent manner. The fact that INDEPENDENCE helps to explain the intuitive verdict in the calculation case discussed above does lend it some plausibility. But as already noted, some proponents of conciliatory theories deny that we are always required to rely only (or even primarily) on dispute-independent reasons in responding to disagreement. Thus, even if INDEPENDENCE is on the right track, there may be features of religious disagreements that distinguish them from the calculation case and that weaken or render inapplicable the anti-question-begging requirement that applies in the calculation case.

One potentially significant difference between religious disagreements and the calculation case (and similar cases that are used to motivate INDEPENDENCE) is that in many religious disagreements, there is no clear basis for arriving at a dispute-independent judgment concerning the epistemic qualifications of the parties to the dispute (Pittard 2014). In the calculation case, the robust track record information provides a good dispute-independent basis for estimating the reliability of each friend in answering questions like the one under dispute. But consider a dispute between, say, a theist and an atheist. What nonpartisan, dispute-independent grounds do the disputants have for arriving at an estimation of their epistemic credentials concerning the question of God’s existence? One might think that they should compare their track record on other religious questions: for example, whether a relationship with God would be a great good, whether the sorts of suffering we observe in this world could be redeemed by God (should God exist), or whether there are plausible naturalistic and non-teleological explanations for the existence and character of our universe. However, it is quite clear that this procedure is unlikely to yield a nonpartisan assessment of their respective epistemic credentials. The atheist and theist will probably disagree on these questions as well, for reasons that are not independent of their dispute concerning theism, preventing them from arriving at a dispute-independent calculation of their “religious track record.”

If religious track records cannot provide the atheist and the theist with a basis for a nonpartisan assessment of epistemic credentials, one might think that they can arrive at such an assessment by considering the degree to which they each exhibit the intellectual capacities and epistemic advantages that are most important for a reliable assessment of religious claims. For example, they could estimate one another’s intelligence and analytic sophistication by means of some indicator like academic performance, and through conversation they could perhaps ascertain how extensively each of them has studied topics relevant to an assessment of theism. Unfortunately, in a wide range of religious disputes, this sort of procedure is unlikely to deliver a dispute-neutral assessment of epistemic credentials. This is because many systems of religious belief include incompatible views on what qualifies one to reliably assess religious claims. In this respect, religious disagreement is quite different from controversies in many other domains. Two civil engineers with opposing views on the merits of some bridge proposal will most likely agree on what sort of training and cognitive capacities are required to be a good judge of engineering questions, and they probably agree on which institutional signals (for example, academic degrees, professional experience, publications) serve as reliable evidence that someone possesses the requisite capacities. In many religious disputes, however, whether the disputed proposition is true or false has significant implications for the question of which qualifications best position one to assess the disputed proposition. Some Buddhists, for example, maintain that meditative disciplines are required in order to loosen the grip of certain delusions and to enable an adequate appreciation of the truth of Buddhist teachings concerning the non-existence of a personal self. Those who have considered Buddhism and who are not convinced are unlikely to accept that these meditative disciplines are an important qualification for an assessment of Buddhist claims. To consider another example, a Christian, inspired by the apostle Paul’s writings in I Corinthians 1-2, might affirm that scholarly credentials and analytic sophistication do not help one to see the truth of the Christian message, but that the key qualification is the possession of a divinely-given insight into the beauty and excellence of God as portrayed in the Christian message. Non-Christians will clearly not share this view concerning which qualifications are most important.

In many religious disputes, then, questions about which qualifications are most important cannot be separated from the primary religious matter under dispute, so that there is no shared theory of epistemic credentials that could ground a dispute-independent assessment of the disputants’ qualifications. If Christensen’s moderate conciliatory position is right and significant conciliation is required only when one has positive dispute-independent reasons for trusting the other side, and if in many religious disagreements there is no basis for a dispute-independent assessment of epistemic qualifications since questions about which credentials are relevant are caught up in the dispute at hand, then it seems that the correct conciliatory view may not require significant conciliation in many religious disputes.

Against this conclusion, one might protest that even if there is no nonpartisan theory of epistemic credentials that one can employ for a dispute-independent assessment of epistemic qualifications, it is quite probable that one’s own partisan view on epistemic credentials will give one reason to trust the other side. And if that is the case, then surely conciliation will be required. Suppose that atheists maintain that the most significant qualification in assessing theism is the possession of philosophical aptitude, and that theists maintain that the most significant qualification is a selfless love for others, which they think properly disposes the heart to see the truth of “divine things.” While there is no dispute-neutral theory of epistemic credentials in this case, it is certainly possible that the atheists’ own theory will give them a reason to assign significant weight to the views of theists if there are numerous theists who are philosophically qualified, and that the theists’ own theory will give them a reason to assign significant weight to the views of the atheists if atheists exhibit just as much selfless love as theists. In this case, both sides would, by their own light, have reason to significantly reduce confidence in their respective views. In fact, we could say that both sides do have a dispute-independent reason for trusting the other side, the reason being that on either of the competing theories concerning which credentials are most relevant, there is reason to think the other side highly qualified.

As the above rejoinder shows, the mere lack of a common perspective on the relevant epistemic credentials is not enough to escape the threat posed by disagreement, even given a more moderate conciliatory view like Christensen’s. Conflicting theories of epistemic credentials will alleviate the worries posed by disagreement only if one’s partisan theory of epistemic credentials does not give one strong reason to trust the other side. Is there any reason to think that a theory of epistemic credentials that is part of some religious belief system will not supply strong reasons for thinking that adherents of other belief systems are epistemically qualified? This is, ultimately, an empirical matter that must be settled on a case by case basis: what does a given religious viewpoint say about which epistemic credentials are most important when it comes to religious matters? Does the theory of epistemic credentials implied by the religious perspective give strong reasons for thinking that many of those who reject the religious perspective in question are nonetheless epistemically qualified? Clearly, the answers to these questions could vary depending on which religious perspective we are inquiring about. Pittard (2014) gives some reasons to think that, in many cases at least, religiously-motivated theories of epistemic credentials will not supply strong reasons for thinking that those who reject the viewpoint in question are epistemically qualified. First, the credentials that are emphasized by religious traditions are often credentials the possession of which is not easily discernible. Taking inspiration from Jesus’ sermon on the mount, suppose that “purity of heart,” that is, untainted desire for God, is necessary in order to see the truth of divine things. Unlike more standard epistemic credentials that are relevant in mundane domains of inquiry, purity of heart is not something whose presence in one’s disputant can easily be confirmed or disconfirmed. And if the most important epistemic credentials pertaining to religious questions are unobservable, then one may not have very strong reasons for thinking that one’s disputant is qualified with respect to religious matters. Second, many systems of religious belief feature credentials that are unlikely to be possessed by someone who is not disposed to accept the belief system in question. Consider a Theravada Buddhist who maintains that the truth of “emptiness” is unlikely to be evident apart from substantial engagement in Buddhist meditation. While it is perhaps easy to confirm whether or not someone has practiced Buddhist meditative practices in a disciplined way, it is unlikely that someone would pursue years of Buddhist meditation unless she was already positively disposed towards Buddhism. When the putative epistemic credentials are self-selecting in this way, it is less likely that there will be large numbers of disbelievers who possess the credentials.

If (i) a dispute-independent evaluation does not provide strong reasons for thinking that the other side of a religious dispute is as credentialed as one’s own side, (ii) one’s own partisan theory of religious epistemic credentials also does not supply such a reason, and (iii) significant conciliation is required in disagreements only to the extent that one has strong reasons for thinking that the qualifications of those on the other side of the dispute rival or surpass the qualifications of one’s own side, as Christensen asserts, then the skeptical implications of religious disagreement may be quite limited.

Against this line of thinking, some have complained that a view on disagreement is too weak if it allows religious believers to set aside worries raised by disagreement simply because their religiously-motivated theory of epistemic credentials does not give them reason to highly estimate the credentials of their disputants. Lackey (2014, 308), for example, notes that we should not affirm the reasonableness of the sexist who dismisses disagreement-related worries on the grounds that his disputant is a woman. Similarly, she insists that one should not be able to escape worries raised by religious disagreement simply by affirming a partisan and contestable view on the nature of the relevant epistemic credentials. In response, one could point out that while the sexist’s position after dismissing his female disputant is highly unreasonable, this is compatible with its being the case that he applied the correct policy for responding to disagreements. The unreasonableness of his final position may be explained by the unreasonableness of the sexist views he held before the dispute, and not by the employment of an incorrect disagreement norm. After all, we should not expect that applying the right disagreement norm will correct for rational failures that one brings into a disagreement situation. Lackey considers this response and answers as follows: “If an atheist sticks to her guns with respect to her belief that God does not exist just by regarding the theist as her epistemic inferior, this is irrationality in her response to a disagreement. It is not clear what could justify relegating these failures of rationality to epistemology generally rather than to the epistemology of disagreement in particular” (311).

What follows if Lackey’s more expansive conception of the epistemology of disagreement is granted? Perhaps the correct disagreement norm will still allow that the significance of religious disagreement is sensitive to one’s theory of epistemic credentials, but with the added caveat that one’s theory of epistemic credentials can mitigate the worries raised by disagreement only if one’s adherence to the theory is reasonable and not just an unmotivated attempt to block disagreement worries. It isn’t clear how this changes the dialectical situation, since adherents of a particular religiously-motivated theory of epistemic credentials presumably think that their theory is reasonable, and thus not analogous to the prejudice of the sexist. On the other hand, the correct disagreement norm could deny that the evidential significance of religious disagreement is sensitive to what theory of epistemic credentials one happens to hold. One way to do this would be for the disagreement norm to simply stipulate the correct theory of epistemic credentials. But this would require taking a stand on questions that are contested on religious grounds. The resultant norm could not supply a religiously neutral motivation for religious skepticism. Alternatively, the norm could require that one’s assessment of a disagreement always be dispute-neutral, and that equal weight be assigned to both sides in those cases where there is no agreement on the relevant credentials. But such a strong conciliatory norm would require capitulation in disagreements with radical skeptics, which is what led Christensen and others to search for principled conciliatory policies with more modest anti-question-begging constraints. In short, it is not clear whether there is a conciliatory norm that is religiously neutral and not overly skeptical, but that completely forbids relying on one’s particular theory of epistemic credentials in assessing the significance of a religious disagreement.

It should be emphasized that a moderate conciliatory view like Christensen’s will require reduction of confidence in many religious disputes, even if it does not require significant conciliation in inter-religious disputes where the two sides share very little common ground. Significant doxastic revision will likely be required in a wide range of religious disputes between those with broadly similar positions. Consider a disagreement between two theologians who disagree over the finer details of some shared theological framework. Given their extensive theological agreement, each party to the dispute has strong dispute-independent reasons for thinking that the other person is quite reliable as a guide to theological matters. This suggests that a moderate conciliatory framework of the sort considered here would call for significant deference. So even if outright religious skepticism is not required, believers might be required to loosen their religious views by adopting an agnostic stance towards many intramural disputes.

5. Fundamental Versus Superficial Disagreements

In philosophical discussions of disagreement, one frequently encounters the view that fundamental disagreements—that is, disagreements driven by incompatible epistemic starting points—should occasion less doxastic revision than disagreements that are superficial. Many who readily concede that disagreement can easily defeat one’s belief about the answer to a multistep math problem, for example, deny that one’s fundamental moral, philosophical, or religious convictions are similarly vulnerable in the face of disagreement. The previous section pointed to one reason that arguably goes some way towards explaining why fundamental disagreements might be less worrying than superficial ones: it might be that in fundamental disagreements, it is unclear what the relevant epistemic credentials are and who possesses them, making it unlikely that one will have strong independent grounds for thinking that the epistemic credentials of those on the other side of a dispute either rival or surpass the credentials of one’s own side. This section briefly considers two different accounts as to why religious disagreements that are suitably fundamental will pose less of a skeptical threat, and then considers whether religious disagreements are fundamental in the relevant sense.

Bogardus (2013b) argues that while peer disagreement undermines what he calls “knowledge from reports,” it does not undermine “knowledge from direct acquaintance.” Knowledge from reports, according to Bogardus, is mediated knowledge that rests on the output of some cognitive faculty, while knowledge from direct acquaintance involves “immediate and unproblematic access” (9) to the truth of the known proposition. In a case of knowledge that p from direct acquaintance, one “just sees” that p is the case, and p is part of one’s evidence base. Bogardus cites our knowledge that 2+2=4 as a paradigmatic example of such knowledge. In a case of knowledge that p from a report, one does not “see” p directly but sees p by seeing q, where q is some proposition concerning the report of one or more cognitive faculties. In this case, q but not p is part of one’s evidence. A paradigmatic example of knowledge from reports would be a belief based on memory. Christensen’s bill calculation case also seems to be a case where something known from a report is the subject of peer disagreement. When one of the friends concludes that each person’s share is $43, he does not “just see” that $43 is the correct answer. Rather, what he “just sees” is that the answer he has reached after a series of calculative steps (many of which he probably does not remember) is $43, and this is the basis for his belief that each person’s share is $43.

Assuming that there are these two types of knowledge, it is not implausible to think that knowledge from direct acquaintance is less susceptible to higher-order defeat than knowledge from reports. Because knowledge from reports involves trusting the “readouts” of one’s “cognitive instrument,” such knowledge is understandably threatened by worries raised about the reliability of that instrument or by the fact that some other similar instrument–an epistemic peer–delivers an inconsistent “readout.” Knowledge by direct acquaintance, on the other hand, is more fundamental to one’s cognitive perspective in that it is not mediated by instrumental reports. If such knowledge is not based on the report of one’s cognitive faculties, that knowledge may not be similarly undercut when one learns that an epistemic peer’s faculties deliver an inconsistent report. Therefore, on Bogardus’ view, if a contested religious belief is known by direct acquaintance, or if a religious belief is based on some contested proposition that is known by direct acquaintance, then the party who enjoys such knowledge rationally ought to stand by the belief in the face of disagreement.

A second account as to why fundamental disagreements may pose less of a skeptical threat comes from Gellman (1993, 355ff.). Gellman argues that religious beliefs may be immune to defeat by disagreement if those beliefs are numbered among the “rock bottom” epistemological starting points that supply the basis for epistemic evaluation of other beliefs. However religious believers may have come to initially acquire their religious beliefs, for many believers these beliefs come to achieve rock bottom status, alongside other commitments, such as basic rational principles and fundamental beliefs about the world, that serve as justifiers of other beliefs and that do not themselves stand in need of grounding. Gellman acknowledges that there is a hierarchy among such rock-bottom beliefs: some of these beliefs are given more weight in rational deliberation, and some are given priority in that they invariably trump other rock-bottom commitments in cases when they conflict. He also holds that for many religious believers, core religious beliefs are hierarchically prior to many of the rational norms identified by epistemologists, including norms like DEFERENCE and INDEPENDENCE described above. Given this priority, Gellman maintains that it would not be rational for the religious believer to abandon core religious beliefs just because this is what DEFERENCE and INDEPENDENCE require.

It is, of course, questionable whether the above thinkers are right in thinking that beliefs that are suitably fundamental are thereby protected from the disagreement threat. Many will question the Cartesian optimism implicit in Bogardus’ conception of knowledge from direct acquaintance. And even if there are fundamental beliefs that are presumed “innocent” and that therefore do not stand in need of evidential support, as Gellman claims, it need not follow that such presumptive innocence remains intact in the face of direct challenge from other qualified thinkers. Finally, even if the significance of disagreement is mitigated in fundamental disputes, it may be that neither Bogardus nor Gellman have adequately articulated the relevant sense of “fundamentality.”

Even once the relevant sense of fundamentality is fully clarified, the question of whether a given religious disagreement is fundamental will in many cases be a controversial one. This is because there is significant disagreement among philosophers of religion on the place that religious belief occupies in the believer’s “noetic structure,” and thus on the source of religious disagreement. Consider, for instance, the conflicting accounts of reflective theistic belief developed by Richard Swinburne (2004) and Alvin Plantinga (2000). Swinburne maintains that reflective theists who are aware of evidential challenges to religious faith, including facts about religious diversity, will typically be unable to take their theistic convictions for granted, but will need to proportion their credence in theism to the evidence. Swinburne holds, moreover, that evidential reasoning about God’s existence can and should employ the same principles of confirmation theory that are widely accepted in the sciences, and that the pre-evidential probabilities that serve as the starting point for such reasoning can and should be sufficiently determined by the application of generally-accepted inductive criteria such as explanatory scope and simplicity. This view seems to suggest that when two equally informed thinkers disagree on the plausibility of theism, the most plausible explanation is that at least one of them has made some mistake in the application of agreed-upon criteria that serve as the epistemic starting points for both parties. If this is right, then there is some reason to think that cases of religious disagreement can be assimilated to the calculation case discussed above, a case of disagreement that seems not to be fundamental since the dispute stems from performance error on the part of one of the thinkers rather than from any fundamental divergence in the disputants’ perspectives antecedent to the process of calculation.

In contrast to Swinburne, Plantinga maintains that for most theists, the belief in God is not the product of inference, but is basic in that it is not based on other beliefs. Plantinga acknowledges that theistic beliefs are often prompted by certain experiences: upon viewing a breathtaking mountain vista, one might find oneself believing that the world was created by God; or after doing some evil act, one might find oneself believing that God disapproves of what one has done. According to Plantinga, however, while these experiences may occasion theistic beliefs, these beliefs are not based on inferential reasoning that appeals to facts about these experiences as evidence. Instead, these beliefs are like the belief in other minds or the reality of the past or in the reliability of memory: such beliefs are held with a high degree of confidence whether or not we are aware of any good arguments in their favor. If Plantinga is right that theistic belief is not typically grounded in evidential reasoning, then there is reason to think that disagreements between theists and atheists are typically fundamental in a way that the disagreement in the calculation case is not. Disagreements over theism would not result from some performance error in inferential reasoning, but would be the product of differences in the basic outlooks of different thinkers.

The aim in comparing Swinburne and Plantinga is not to suggest that if Plantinga is right, theistic belief is fundamental in a way that lessens its vulnerability to defeat by disagreement (or that, if Swinburne is right, theistic belief is more vulnerable to the disagreement threat). While this is a conclusion that some have drawn, the principal aim of the comparison is to show that even if we agreed on a characterization of “fundamentality” that protects beliefs from being defeated by disagreement, there may very well be disagreement concerning the structure of religious belief and the question of whether it is fundamental in the relevant sense. While there is some reason for thinking that Swinburne’s view of theistic belief would place theistic belief on the non-fundamental side, there are also considerations that call this supposition into question. There are potentially significant disanalogies between theistic belief on Swinburne’s picture and the calculation case, which does seem to be a paradigm of a superficial disagreement. For example, in the calculation case, the several steps that led to one’s answer are presumably forgotten, and the exact source of the disagreement cannot be pinpointed. (And if it could be pinpointed, no doubt one party would recognize their error.) One might think that in many religious disagreements, disputants can rehearse the most important steps of the reasoning that grounds their view, and that as a result they can locate the precise point where their reasoning diverges. And a disagreement that persists even when the point of divergence has been identified is quite different from one where the disagreement persists precisely because the two parties cannot reconstruct their reasoning and thus cannot identify the point of divergence. The former sort of disagreement, which is driven by stable differences in how one applies inferential norms, is perhaps fundamental in a way that the calculation disagreement, which results from some obscured performance error, is not.

In addition to questioning whether Swinburne’s picture supports the “non-fundamental” characterization of religious disagreement, there is also room to question whether religious disagreement on Plantinga’s picture really does qualify as fundamental in the relevant sense. While Plantinga maintains that theistic belief is basic, one might argue that on his model theistic belief is an instance of knowledge from reports rather than knowledge from direct acquaintance. Even if theistic belief is not inferred from facts about the report of some cognitive faculty, the believer may believe in response to a report from some cognitive faculty (what Plantinga calls the sensus divinitatis) and may not “just see” that God exists. Consider: basic perceptual beliefs seem susceptible to defeat by disagreement in a way that basic mathematical beliefs are not. If two normal and (up till now) healthy friends are standing before an open garage, and one says he sees a car in the garage and the other says the garage is empty, it is reasonable to suppose that both of them should significantly lower their confidence in their initial belief, since it is likely that someone is hallucinating and neither has reason to think that their friend is more susceptible to hallucination than they are. However, if these two friends are talking and it comes to light that one of them believes that 1+1=2 while the other believes that 1+1=5, it is less plausible to suppose that the friend with the correct belief should reduce confidence to any significant extent. Both of these disagreements arguably involve conflicts between basic beliefs, but basic perceptual beliefs appear to be more vulnerable to defeat than basic mathematical beliefs. Perhaps this is because basic mathematical beliefs arise from a direct awareness of mathematical truths, while perceptual beliefs are mediated by the reports of perceptual faculties. This diagnosis and the preceding discussion involve a number of controversial claims and assumptions, controversies that will not be pursued here. The main point is that from the position that theistic belief is basic, it does not straightforwardly follow that theistic belief is among those beliefs that can plausibly be said to be resistant to defeat by disagreement in virtue of their fundamental status. The relevantly fundamental beliefs may be some subclass of basic beliefs, those that are the product of rational insight rather than the product of some perceptual or quasi-perceptual faculty.

6. Appeals to Religious Experience

For many religious believers, personal religious experience plays a crucial role in the formation, development, and sustaining of religious belief. Theravada Buddhists emphasize the importance of experiences arising from certain meditative disciplines, experiences that open the mind to the truth of certain Buddhist teachings. Charismatic Christians frequently refer to certain bodily sensations that serve as experiential signs of the presence and activity of the Holy Spirit. Theists of various stripes emphasize profound experiences of God’s presence and divine communication, experiences that frequently occur in times of prayer or worship but that may also come unbidden outside of any specific religious practice. In addition to claimed direct experience of God, many believers in God or gods purport to discern providential influence on their circumstances, and not infrequently believers claim to have witnessed or received physical healing in response to prayer. This is, of course, only a sample of the diverse religious experiences that are represented in religious traditions across the globe. Atheists who reject any religious viewpoint may also cite personal experiences in accounting for their disbelief—for example, experiences of silence and absence of divine comfort in a season of acute suffering.

The fact that such experiences frequently play a prominent role in motivating and supporting religious belief is potentially significant for an assessment of the epistemic significance of religious disagreement. Many who argue for the defeating power of disagreement are explicitly concerned with contexts where each side to the dispute has fully disclosed the grounds for their view. If disagreement is most worrying when it persists in context of full disclosure, then there is some reason to think that many religious disagreements will not present serious skeptical threats. To be sure, some “religious experiences” are such that their epistemically relevant content can easily be communicated to others. Suppose someone prays for a new car and the next day receives a car from a complete stranger who says that she felt moved to give her car away. The epistemically relevant aspects of such an experience could easily be communicated to others. (Whether the testimony would be believed is, of course, another story.) But one might think that in many instances of what we call “religious experience,” the content of the experience that is taken to be epistemically relevant cannot be communicated. Suppose that someone in desperate straits cries out to God for help and immediately experiences a “peace that surpasses all understanding” (Philippians 4:7), a peace that seems in its profundity to be a divine gift rather than a purely natural phenomenon. Could someone who believes in God partly on the basis of such experience fully disclose his reasons for belief? He could, of course, report having such an experience and describe the belief changes that seemed appropriate in its wake. However, the epistemic significance of the experience may significantly depend on subjective aspects of the experience whose qualities cannot be adequately communicated by means of verbal testimony (James 1902, 371). If this is right, then religious disagreements may be quite different from disagreements in many other domains where the subjective qualities of private experiences do not play a significant epistemic role.

There are reasons for doubting whether the significance of religious experience to religious belief could justify both sides of a religious dispute in confidently maintaining their religious beliefs in the face of disagreement (Schellenberg 2007, 182-3). Consider a disagreement between a Buddhist and a Muslim who both appeal to distinctive sorts of experiences in justifying their contested religious beliefs. While the Muslim does not herself experience the same sort of ineffable experiences that ground the Buddhist’s belief in, say, the doctrine of non-self, the Buddhist can tell the Muslim of his experiences and he can describe the doxastic responses that seem to him appropriate in light of the experiences. If the Muslim trusts the judgment of the Buddhist, then it seems that the Buddhist’s belief in non-self constitutes evidence that his experiences, combined with his other evidence, supply good evidence for the doctrine of non-self. Furthermore, evidence that there is good evidence for p is often itself evidence for p. Hence, the Buddhist’s belief in response to the reported experience may serve as a piece of proxy evidence that stands in for the experience itself. Since this proxy evidence is available to the Muslim, it seems that the incommunicability of the Buddhist’s experience does not prevent that experience from having indirect evidential weight for the Muslim. Of course, a symmetrical story can be told as to why the Muslim’s report of mystical experiences and her doxastic response can serve as proxy evidence that stands in for the experience itself and can be appreciated by the Buddhist. Assuming that both attach comparable weight to their experiences and have responded with equal conviction, there is arguably no reason for either thinker to maintain that his or her own experience should be given more evidential weight than the inaccessible experience of the trustworthy interlocutor. On this view, the inaccessibility of religious experience is unlikely to relieve religious believers of the worries raised by religious disagreement. As long as multiple sides accord significant weight to private experiences, there is a kind of epistemic symmetry that arguably demands a skeptical response.

Still, one might resist the above reasoning by noting, first, that we do not have some metric that we can use to measure and compare the apparent evidential value of various mystical experiences. We communicate the perceived evidential significance of our experience through coarse-grained descriptive language, like “a deep and incredibly profound sense of God’s love” or “a brilliantly clear insight into the unity of all things,” language that is not calibrated in a way that would allow us to make reliable interpersonal comparisons of the significance of different mystical experiences. It is possible that two speakers could both be reasonable in describing their religious experiences as, say, “utterly profound and clarifying” even though one person’s experience was in fact much more profound and clarifying than the other’s. The fact that two people use similarly strong language to describe their experiences is poor evidence that the experiences were comparable in their epistemic import. Of course, this by itself does not give one any reason for thinking that one’s own experience is likely to be more significant than someone else’s similarly-described experience. All the same, consider the case of some religious believer who has had a mystical experience of arresting intensity and profundity, and who attempts to convey the significance of this experience using fairly extreme language, and then discovers that believers from opposing standpoints use similarly extreme language to convey the apparent significance of their own mystical experiences. If the religious believer thinks that it is quite plausible that people would use similarly extreme vocabulary even if their experiences were much less profound and compelling than his own, and if he can easily entertain the possibility of others having less compelling experiences than his own but cannot easily entertain the possibility of others having experiences that are more compelling than his own, then he might be reasonable in believing that his own experience is evidentially more significant than the experiences of his disputants (despite the fact that these experiences are similarly described). According to this reasoning, religious belief that is grounded in surprisingly powerful experiences might be reasonably held in the face of religious disagreement even if multiple sides cite similar “powerful” religious experiences in explaining their view.

7. Faith and Practical Responses to the Problem of Religious Disagreement

Epistemic or “theoretical” rationality is the sort of rationality that is principally exhibited by someone’s beliefs, and the norms of epistemic rationality are concerned with such matters as logical consistency and evidential support. Practical rationality, on the other hand, is the sort of rationality that is principally exhibited by someone’s actions, and the norms of practical rationality are concerned with such matters as the compatibility of one’s various goals and the degree to which one’s actions conduce towards the attainment of those goals. The discussion thus far has proceeded under the assumption that whether religious conviction is rational in light of disagreement is a matter to be settled by the norms of epistemic rather than practical rationality. This assumption is contested by many who maintain that the reasonability of religious belief, or at least of religious faith, is best evaluated from the standpoint of practical rather than (or in addition to) epistemic rationality. According to these thinkers, reasonable religious conviction is often based not on the sort of evidential reasons that bear on the question of whether religious claims are true or probable, but instead on moral, prudential, or existential reasons for thinking that it would be in some way good or valuable to have some particular religious commitment. For example, a theist might believe in God for the reason that belief in God gives her a sense of deep purpose, both for her own life and for the cosmos as a whole, or because it helps her to maintain her moral commitments even when they lead to significant suffering. If religious belief may be rational in light of such practical reasons, and if religious disagreement does not pose a threat to the practical justification of religious belief in the same way that it threatens its epistemic justification, then the claim that religious belief ought to be abandoned on account of religious disagreement is arguably more questionable.

It might seem that practical reasons could make religious convictions rational only if those convictions are based on practical reasons, and religious convictions can be based on practical reasons only if they are voluntary. Many philosophers maintain that beliefs are not voluntary, and for this reason are not evaluable according to the norms of practical rationality. If this is right, then the rationality of religious belief is arguably a matter of epistemic rather than practical rationality. The faith of the religious “believer” may not always be an instance of belief in the conventional sense, however. Of the philosophers who have considered the nature of faith, a good number have argued for a “non-cognitive” conception of faith that does not require outright belief in the propositions that are the object of faith. On Alston’s (1996) view, for example, one may fail to believe a proposition while nonetheless “accepting” it as a matter of faith. Such acceptance is like belief in many respects—one views the world from a standpoint that takes the accepted proposition for granted, and one employs the accepted proposition as a premise in practical reasoning—but acceptance is a voluntary state that does not require believing the proposition or judging it to be more probable than not.

Even if non-cognitivists about faith are wrong and belief is essential to faith, there could still be reasons why religious faith is appropriately evaluated from the standpoint of practical rationality rather than (or in addition to) epistemic rationality. First, some contest the claim that belief is inevitably involuntary. William James (1896), for example, argues that belief is governed by two competing aims (“Believe truth! Shun error!”), and how these aims are prioritized in a given context may be a voluntary matter that helps to determine whether one ends up believing a given claim. Second, even if belief cannot be chosen in the rather direct manner supposed by James, there is little doubt that one can undertake courses of action that may indirectly influence one’s religious beliefs.

Granting that religious faith is responsive to practical reasons, either because it is a voluntary state that does not require belief at all or because religious belief can be directly chosen or indirectly influenced by voluntary means, what implications does this have for the rational significance of religious disagreement? Holley (2013) suggests that if commitment to a religious way of life is valuable, then religious belief will likely be practically rational. For engaging in a religious way of life tends to produce religious beliefs, and the exercise of epistemic discipline that would be required to avoid falling into belief is likely to be incompatible with genuinely entering into the way of life in question. For this reason, Holley maintains that one can be reasonable in persisting in religious belief even if systematic religious disagreement defeats the epistemic justification of religious belief. Just how much erosion of epistemic support can the practical grounds for faith tolerate? The answer is by no means clear. For example, even if one can reasonably accept a proposition for which one has a credence of around 0.5 (a credence that might be insufficient for belief), there still could be non-trivial credence thresholds below which acceptance is not practically rational. If this is right, then the degree to which a given claim enjoys epistemic support is not irrelevant to an assessment of the practical rationality of accepting that claim. Those who argue on Jamesian grounds that belief can be responsive to practical considerations often hold that believed propositions must be judged more probable than not, and that this judgment of probability should be responsive to purely epistemic considerations (Pace 2011). As these examples suggest, the mere fact that practical considerations are relevant to an assessment of religious faith does not mean that the practical rationality of faith can be settled without reference to its epistemic merits.

Even if we agreed that the merits of some religious belief that p should be evaluated according to purely practical criteria that in no way depend on the strength of the epistemic reasons for the belief, it is still possible that knowledge of religious disagreement could constitute a defeater that renders religious belief unreasonable. This is because in addition to disagreements about the truth of various religious truth claims, there is also disagreement concerning the merits of various practical or “pragmatic” arguments for religious belief. This disagreement could undermine the epistemic justification of the beliefs that constitute the practical grounds for religious belief, and one might think that a practical rationale whose epistemic justification has been defeated cannot ground reasonable religious belief. Suppose that Theo believes in God on purely practical grounds. Perhaps Theo believes on the basis of a Kantian argument that concludes that belief in God is important in order to engage in the moral life without despair. Alternatively, perhaps Theo believes for the Kierkegaardian reason that passionate commitment in the face of “objective uncertainty” is the highest form of human existence. Still another possibility, his faith might be a response to the prudential reasoning articulated in Pascal’s “Wager” argument. All of these arguments are the subject of immense controversy. If these arguments must be epistemically justified in order to make it practically rational to have religious faith, then disagreement would threaten to undermine religious faith even if the religious claims that are accepted by faith do not themselves stand in need of epistemic justification. Moreover, several opponents of religious faith offer arguments for the conclusion that religious belief is positively harmful, either to the believer or to society as a whole (Fumerton 2013). Practically rational religious belief arguably requires that one be epistemically justified in rejecting such arguments, but disagreement of the right sort might undercut such justification.

8. Conclusion

Even if individual attempts at characterizing the rational significance of religious disagreement prove controversial, for many thinkers, including many religious believers, the intuition that persistent religious disagreement poses a significant challenge to religious belief is incredibly strong. As this article has attempted to show, clarifying the nature and scope of that challenge requires not only that one resolve various controversial questions in the epistemology of disagreement, but also that one settle difficult questions concerning such matters as the place of religious belief in the noetic structure of religious believers, the epistemic significance of various types of religious experiences, the role played by practical reasons in grounding religious conviction, and the theories of religious epistemic credentials implied by various religious belief systems. Given the complexity of such questions, there is little doubt that the epistemic significance of religious disagreement will remain a topic of lively philosophical dispute.

9. References and Further Reading

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Alston, William P. 1991. Perceiving God: The Epistemology of Religious Experience. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press.
Alston, William P. 1996. “Belief, Acceptance, and Religious Faith.” In Faith, Freedom, and Rationality, edited by Jeff Jordan and Daniel Howard-Snyder, 3–27. Lanham, MD: Rowman & Littlefield.
Baldwin, Erik, and Michael Thune. 2008. “The Epistemological Limits of Experience-Based Exclusive Religious Belief.” Religious Studies 44 (04): 445–55.
Basinger, David. 1999. “The Challenge of Religious Diversity: A Middle Ground.” Sophia 38 (1): 41–53.
Basinger, David. 2002. Religious Diversity: A Philosophical Assessment. Aldershot, UK: Ashgate.
Bogardus, Tomas. 2013a. “The Problem of Contingency for Religious Belief.” Faith and Philosophy 30 (4): 371–92.
Bogardus, Tomas. 2013b. “Disagreeing with the (Religious) Skeptic.” International Journal for Philosophy of Religion 74 (1): 5–17.
Bourget, David, and David Chalmers. 2009. “The PhilPapers Surveys: Results, Analysis, and Discussion.” Accessed August 5, 2015. http://philpapers.org/surveys/.
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Christensen, David. 2009. “Disagreement as Evidence: The Epistemology of Controversy.” Philosophy Compass 4 (5): 756–67.
Christensen, David. 2010. “Higher-Order Evidence.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 81 (1): 185–215.
Christensen, David. 2011. “Disagreement, Question-Begging and Epistemic Self-Criticism.” Philosophers’ Imprint 11 (6): 1–22.
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James, William. 1896. The Will to Believe and Other Essays in Popular Philosophy. New York: Longmans, Green and Co.
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Kelly, Thomas. 2005. “The Epistemic Significance of Disagreement.” Oxford Studies in Epistemology 1: 167–96.
Kelly, Thomas. 2011. “Consensus Gentium: Reflections on the ‘Common Consent’ Argument for the Existence of God.” In Evidence and Religious Belief, edited by Kelly James Clark and Raymond J. VanArragon, 135–56. New York: Oxford University Press.
Kelly, Thomas. 2013. “Disagreement and the Burdens of Judgment.” In The Epistemology of Disagreement: New Essays, edited by David Christensen and Jennifer Lackey. Oxford University Press.
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McKim, R. 2001. Religious Ambiguity and Religious Diversity. Oxford University Press, USA.
Pace, Michael. 2011. “The Epistemic Value of Moral Considerations: Justification, Moral Encroachment, and James’ ‘Will To Believe.’” Noûs 45 (2): 239–68.
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Vavova, Katia. 2014. “Moral Disagreement and Moral Skepticism.” Philosophical Perspectives 28 (1): 302–33.
White, Roger. 2005. “Epistemic Permissiveness.” Philosophical Perspectives 19 (1): 445–59.

Author Information

John Pittard
Email: john.pittard@yale.edu
Yale University
U. S. A.

Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy