Dai Zhen (Tai Chen, 1724—1777)

daizhen Dai Zhen, also known as Dai Dongyuan (Tai Tung-yuan), was a philosopher and intellectual polymath believed by many to be the most important Confucian scholar of the Qing (Ch’ing) dynasty (1644-1911). He was also the foremost figure among the sophisticated new class of career academics who rose to prominence in the mid-Qing. A prominent critic of the Confucian orthodoxy of the Song and Ming dynasties (known today in the West as “Neo-Confucianism”), Dai charged his predecessors with philosophical errors that had dire moral consequences for their adherents and brilliantly showed them to be rooted in misreadings of the Confucian classics. Chief among these errors was the tendency to understand feelings and desires as being obstacles to proper moral deliberation and action, a view that Dai saw as opening to the door to frictionless moral judgments, free of calculations of benefit or harm and not responsible to the felt responses of others. Dai aimed to restore feelings and desires to prominence by assigning a central place to sympathetic concern (shu) in moral deliberation. He thus reconceived the fundamental nature of the Neo-Confucian universe in a way that explained moral claims in terms of the human affects. He accomplished this dramatic reconfiguration of the Neo-Confucian thought against the backdrop of social institutions that showed little enthusiasm for, and sometimes outright hostility to, his philosophical endeavors.

Life and Works
Moral Agency
1. Dai’s Critique of the Neo-Confucian Account
2. Sympathy as a Form of Moral Deliberation
Human Nature and Moral Cultivation
Metaphysics and Metaethics
Influence
References and Further Reading

1. Life and Works

Born in 1724 to a poor cloth merchant of Anhui province, Dai Zhen emerged from an unlikely educational background, attending local schools because his father could not afford the customary private tutorials. By the time Dai was eighteen, however, his genius and scholarly accomplishment had won him the acclaim of his elders and shortly thereafter the backing of a reputable literary scholar in his own clan. Bolstered by a series of endorsements and his own evident academic success, Dai came under the tutelage of the famous classicist Jiang Yong (1681-1762), through whom he became acquainted with many figures in the thriving community of mid-Qing academics. Dai soon proved to be not just a precocious and prolific scholar but a versatile one as well. His 1753 commentary on the Poetry Classic was finished contemporaneously with his first major work in phonology, and both followed closely on the heels of a celebrated treatise in mathematics. Although Dai’s interest in philosophical topics was evident quite early, he did not finish his best-known treatises in this field of intellectual endeavor until late in life, the two most important being On the Good (Yuan Shan) and An Evidential Study of the Meaning and Terms of the Mencius (Mengzi ziyi shuzheng). Between these it is the Evidential Study that is generally regarded as his masterwork, being widely appreciated for its sophistication and rigor. By his own account, hisEvidential Study was his greatest labor of love. Several of the last years of his life were spent writing and revising it, and it is likely that he would have continued to revise the work if it were not for his untimely death 1777.

Dai became a leading figure in the dominant new philological or evidential studies (kaozheng) movement, partly because of his interest in mathematics, calendrical studies, and ancient languages and partly because of his exacting standards of argument. Yet Dais relationship to the philological movement was an uneasy one. Like other philological thinkers, he shared an interest in using hard evidence and careful exegesis to reconstruct the language and practices of the ancients. He also shared with many of them the deep conviction that the orthodox Confucianism of Zhu Xi (1130-1200), which by his time had reigned for several centuries, was thoroughly contaminated with Daoist and Buddhist ideas and needed to be corrected with the tools of evidential scholarship. But Dais contemporaries in philological studies tended to believe that the misreadings and obfuscations of orthodox Confucianism were an inevitable part of theoretical speculation about the meanings and principles (yili) of the classics. For Dai, in contrast, the purpose of evidential studies was to reconstruct the meanings and principlesincluding the ethics and metaphysicsof the Confucian canons ancient authors.

This difference of opinion regarding the study of meanings and principles appears to have led Dai to part with his philological contemporaries in two crucial ways. First, while the professional scholars of his time increasingly valued specialization in certain subfields such as astronomy or geography, Dai nevertheless remained a devoted generalist, seeing all of the various disciplines as potentially working together to reconstruct the often highly theoretical meanings of terms and moral practices contained in the classics. Second, while Dais contemporaries believed it was his contributions in fields such as phonology and mathematics that made him the most formidable scholar of his time, Dai himself believed his greatest contributions to be his treatises on such theoretical topics as human nature, metaphysics, and (especially) moral deliberation and cultivation. In his own lifetime Dais highest accolade was a prestigious position on the staff that compiled the Complete Collection of the Four Treasuries (Sikuquanshu) for the Imperial Librarya collection of classic texts that heavily favoredworks of philological interest. Admirers in Dais own era regarded his treatises on meanings and principles as a monumental waste of time, and most of his early biographers barely mentioned such work, even though it became the central focus of his thought and efforts by the end of his life. But while Dais more speculative labors may have been judged harshly in the mid-Qing, his own appraisal of his work and its importance has been vindicated by later scholars. He has come to be hailed as the foremost representative of Qing dynasty philosophy and is routinely presented as such in surveys of Chinese thought.

2. Moral Agency

a. Dai’s Critique of the Neo-Confucian Account

Dai presents his best-known philosophical work, the Evidential Study, as an indictment of Neo-Confucianism. Of particular concern to him is the reigning orthodoxy of Cheng Yi (1033-1107) and Zhu Xi (1130-1200), whose thought had been deeply embedded in China’s governing institutions for centuries, and whose very moral and metaphysical language had come into popular use. At the heart of Dai’s critique is an array of worries about the Neo-Confucian picture of moral agency, where acting well is conceived primarily as a matter of freeing certain native, spontaneous instincts from the influence of feelings and desires. Of particular concern to Dai is the view that merely by eliminating or paring away such feelings and desires one can somehow become a good moral agent. As Dai sees it, this view neglects not just the deliberative, non-spontaneous work that one must do in order to act well, but also the crucial role that affects should play in those deliberations. Thus his critique is aimed in particular at the idea that our native instincts, once freed of the influence of our feelings and desires, are somehow “complete and self-sufficient”—adequate by themselves to give proper moral guidance (Evidential Study, ch. 14, 27).

In Dai’s view, this Neo-Confucian account is factually wrong, and as such does profound injustice to the role that education and cultivation should have in the development of the moral understanding. If we see our work in moral self-cultivation as primarily subtractive or eliminative—as a matter of overcoming bad feelings and desires so as to let the refined parts of the nature act of their own accord—then, Dai maintains, it makes no sense to think of moral education as contributing to the growth and maturation of the moral understanding. What we learn in the process of study (xue) might be understood as having instrumental value, helping to free us from the grip of our bad dispositions and realize the dormant moral sensibilities in ourselves, but once that is accomplished the content of our knowledge would seem to play noconstitutive part in moral comprehension. It is this demotion of education to mere instrument that the erudite Dai Zhen finds to be deeply mistaken. When we learn from the classics, he argues, they have a transformative effect on the faculty of the understanding (xinzhi), helping it to see the morally salient features of one’s life more clearly and respond more appropriately (ch. 14). Just as the nourishment of food and water actually becomes a part of the thing it is meant to nourish, he maintains, so too do the contributions of one’s education become, in a psychological analogue to digestion, a part of the understanding (ch. 9, 26).

Dai is particularly troubled by the pernicious effects the Neo-Confucian account has on its adherents—and, after centuries of Neo-Confucian orthodoxy, on popular culture as well. When the account is strictly followed, he argues, it does not allow the feelings of others to have the right kind of purchase on our own moral evaluations and judgments. If the principal work of moral action lies in eliminating meddlesome emotions, Dai argues, then our deliberations could not be informed by personal acquaintance with the feelings of others (the kind we get from imagining ourselves asthe other person, which is presumably distinct from the kind we get by inferring merely from general rules or observational data). The sentiments stirred by such an acquaintance would be seen as interfering with the authentic expression of the good natural instincts within oneself. Left unchecked by a proper understanding of the felt responses of others, however, Dai maintains that a person’s moral conclusions are at best subjective “opinions” (yijian) and not what Dai calls “invariant norms” (buyi zhi ze)—so named because they represent views that could under ideal circumstances attain a kind of universal agreement across all times and places (ch. 4, 42). In several remarkable passages, Dai writes movingly about the abuses of power that such a doctrine would condone when adopted by those in a position to impose their decisions on the weak or institutionally disadvantaged, unconstrained by the feelings of the helpless people most affected by such decisions (ch. 5, 10).

Another pernicious feature of the Neo-Confucian account, and for Dai Zhen the most alarming one, is that it prevents proper consideration of benefits and harms from figuring in one’s moral deliberations. This problem inspires Dai’s most passionate remarks, as he notes repeatedly how the Neo-Confucian view would blind its adherents to the detrimental effects of their own actions. Unable to consult their desires, he argues, moral agents would have no practicable way of discerning what really matters to the well-being of others (nor, he hints, would they even be capable of recognizing what would or would not contribute to their own well-being). Combined with the first worry, about the inability of others’ claims to suitably inform one’s own personal deliberations, this leaves agents in what Dai describes as “a state of profound blindness,” unable to know what behaviors qualify as good and incapable of being alerted to their mistakes by others (ch. 4). When the doctrine of native self-sufficiency is deeply embraced, Dai concludes, “its harm is great, and yet no one is able to be aware of it” (ch. 43).

b. Sympathy as a Form of Moral Deliberation

Dai Zhen’s corrective for the shortcomings of the Neo-Confucian view (and its Daoist and Buddhist forebears) is an emotional attitude known as “shu,” whose meaning for Dai most closely approximates what we might call “sympathy” or “sympathetic concern.” The characteristic way of exercising shu, for Dai, is to imagine oneself in another’s shoes and so ask what one might desire if one were that person. By reconstructing another person’s desires one can better appreciate the extent to which certain states of affairs would benefit or harm that person. Dai assumes that some simulation of desires (and resultant feelings) is necessary to take proper account of potential benefits and harms, and he insists that the desire-averse picture of moral action upheld by the Neo-Confucians rules out such an exercise from the start. Thus he concludes that the Neo-Confucian picture is unable to fulfill what he takes to be a fundamental demand of any viable account of moral deliberation.

Not just any exercise of shu will provide reliable information about human well-being. For Dai, as for most other Confucian thinkers, shu can be done well or poorly. Given the rather cerebral form of moral cultivation Dai advocates, he believes that most moral agents need a great deal of education before they can make truly informed judgments. Even with this caveat in mind, however, Dai’s critics and occasionally his admirers have often constructed accounts of shuthat make it all too easy to dismiss.

One temptation for those whose intuitions are driven by the English word “sympathy” is to see Dai as advocating an exercise in mirroring or replicating the psychological states of others, especially their desires. If this were the case, shu would seem a poor indicator of the mirrored person’s well-being, since the person may well want things that are bad for her. But in fact Dai’s account of shu leaves it open to the moral agent to simulate counterfactual psychological states. Strictly speaking, Dai understands shu as the act of “taking oneself and extending it to others” (ch. 15), leaving it to the agent to judge which states would be the appropriate ones to synthesize.

A more common temptation is to say that Dai advocates bringing whatever desires we happen to have into our sympathetic reconstruction of the other’s point of view. If I am a solitary type of person, presumably, then I am to imagine others with the same preference for solitude. But this interpretation leaves Dai vulnerable to the charge of sympathetic paternalism, whereby one reconstructs another’s point of view on the basis of affective predispositions that are not the other’s. If this is how shu is supposed to work, then it would again seem a flawed measure of well-being, for others might benefit a great deal more from friendship and company than I, for instance.

The problem with this reading is that it assigns shu no critical role in selecting the desires that are to be synthesized. Just as the first interpretation depicts shu as naïvely mirroring or replicating the wants of another, the second depicts it as naïvely adopting one’s own wants, with no regard to whether these are true indicators of the other’s well-being. In fact, there is considerable evidence that Dai Zhen, at least in his more cogent moments, understands shu as being much more selective than either of these models would suggest. More than just imagining others with the same desires that one happens to have, Dai also sees shu as helping to identify the desires that really matter for welfare in the first place, which he understands as the desires that contribute to “life” (sheng) or “the fulfillment of life” (sui sheng). These are the basic desires which, upon sufficient reflection, we find that we all share—a common core that belong to what Dai sometimes characterizes as “the ordinary human feelings” (ren zhi changqing) and more often describes as the “true feelings” (qing) (ch. 5). In using shu, Dai suggests, one finds similarities that cut across distinctions in power or position: “If one genuinely returns to oneself and reflects on the true feelings of the weak, the few, the dull, the timid, the diseased, the elderly, the young, the orphaned, or the solitary, can those [true feelings] of these others really be any different from one’s own?” (ch. 2).

While there is evidence to suggest that Dai sees shu as having a robust role in selecting desires, it is less clear what the precise mechanism of selection is supposed to be. Possibly the very exercise of constructing a new point of view is supposed to help free one of the clutter of one’s own misguided or excessively idiosyncratic predilections. And Dai probably sees the special care or concern for a person inherent in shu as drawing attention to the desires that really matter to her, much in the way that grief or love draw attention to the features of a person to which the griever or lover is most attached. Dai also hints that there should be some sort of comparative exercise in shu, where one reconstructs the emotional reactions of others and measures them against those that one would have oneself under similar circumstances.

However Dai understands shu to work in detail, he is emphatic about its use as a form of moral deliberation. So understood, Dai suggests, it relies upon our desires in ways incompatible with the Neo-Confucian account of moral agency. His criticisms point to at least two such ways. First, proper moral action as Dai conceives of it requires that we use our desires in the process of deliberation. Second, it requires that we have a certain baseline of dispositions to want the right things. In other words, moral deliberation requires that we “have desires” both in an occurrent sense (as when I am described as actively feeling some inclination to eat good food) and in a dispositional sense (as when I am described as the kind of person who wants good food, even if I am presently working on an essay and not thinking about food at all). Thus, Dai’s picture of moral agency conflicts with the Neo-Confucian account not just in how it envisions moral deliberation but also in its conception of the kind of person that a good moral agent should be. Dai maintains that good human beings should have robust dispositions to desire beneficial things, which in turn requires that they have a healthy interest in their own well-being or life-fulfillment. Without the desire to “fulfill one’s own life,” Dai contends, one will “regard the despairing conditions of others with indifference” (ch. 10). Dai thus unabashedly asserts that even self-interested desires should figure prominently in the life of the virtuous moral agent.

3. Human Nature and Moral Cultivation

Like most Confucian philosophers, Dai Zhen shows a great deal of interest in the moral proclivities of human nature, a topic which by his time had long taken its bearings from Mencius’ (391-308 BCE) famous claim that the natural dispositions are good, and Xunzi (310-219 BCE) equally renowned polemic against this Mencian view. Although Dai is not alone in taking up this particular debate between Mencius and Xunzi, it nevertheless presents him with an important opportunity to sort through an apparent tension in his work, for it is Mencius that Dai takes to speak with final authority, and yet many of Dai’s own views carry an undisguised debt to Xunzian thinking about the relationship between nature, agency, and self-cultivation. Unlike most major figures who have weighed in on the Mencius-Xunzi debate, then, Dai has an interest in confirming much of Xunzi’s position while showing with great care and nuance how Xunzi’s views can be rendered compatible with the thesis that human dispositions are good by nature.

The parts of Xunzi’s doctrine that resonate most deeply with Dai Zhen concern the need to reshape the natural dispositions. If they are already more or less good, Xunzi reasons, it is hard to see why we would need an education that in any meaningful way transforms them. Our nature would already provide adequate or nearly adequate resources for moral self-improvement. Furthermore, Xunzi is plausibly read as upholding a picture of moral cultivation where the heart-and-mind must often overrule the desires, directing the body to act in ways contrary to the tug of one’s felt inclinations.

Like Xunzi, Dai is particularly concerned to develop a picture of the natural dispositions that would countenance a transformative account of self-cultivation. After all, one of the centerpieces of his philosophical work is a critique of the Neo-Confucian account of cultivation as merely subtractive or eliminative—as helping us to remove the bad parts of our nature, but forming no constitutive part of the cultivated self. Dai also shares with Xunzi the presupposition that this transformation requires some sort of power by the heart-and-mind to overrule the desires, and even uses language nearly identical to Xunzi’s to describe the mechanism of control—likening the heart-and-mind to the ruler (jun) of the body in that it issues orders of “permission or denial” (ke fou) to act on the desires of the latter (ch. 8). Thus Dai believes both that our dispositions begin in need of a great deal of reshaping and that one’s heart-and-mind must often resist the pull of the natural dispositions in order to reshape it.

One can consistently maintain this view while upholding the doctrine of natural goodness, Dai thinks, simply by acknowledging that there are parts of one’s nature that are not manifest in the raw, pre-cultivated state. Dai recognizes (as is now routinely observed) that much of Xunzi’s argument depends on a narrow understanding of “nature,” by which anything that appears before the deliberate activity of moral education is considered natural, and anything that appears afterwards is a product of human artifice. But Dai insists that one’s nature consists of latent capacities as well, potentialities which may not always be immediately manifest but which could nevertheless be said to be part of one’s nature, or in one’s nature, as the potential to grow into a peach tree is in the pit of a peach (ch. 25, 29).

In saying this, Dai takes himself to be making a much stronger and more capacious claim than one might think, for if human beings have in their nature the potential to become good, Dai believes, then this happy outcome could be brought about only by building upon nascent goodness, or virtues, already in existence. In other words, if we are to be capable of both understanding the good and being motivated by it, then we must already have some germ of moral understanding and some ability to delight in the good, even if these moral buds have no discernable effect on our behavior. This is because, as Dai puts it, moral inquiry and study are to one’s moral capacities as the nutritive powers of food and drink are to the material endowments of the body: one cannot use them to nurture or grow their intended objects unless some budding form of that object already exists (ch. 26).

This particular move in Dai’s argument might seem controversial. It assumes, after all, that the operations of moral inquiry and study really are like the nurturing of something that already exists, and not, for example, like the procreation or generation of something entirely new. But underlying this argument is a larger commitment to a picture of moral education as always building on some prior ability to appreciate the relevant norms, and it may have been this commitment that in the end makes the Xunzian account of the natural dispositions untenable in Dai’s eyes. For Dai, even at the earliest stages one learns by drawing upon one’s pre-existing grasp of propriety (li) and righteousness (yi), enlarging and expanding upon the understanding that one already has. In contrast, for Xunzi (as Dai reads him), those who aspire to goodness must start from scratch, without the benefit of nascent tendencies to appreciate the good (ch. 25-26).

4. Metaphysics and Metaethics

Most accounts of Dai Zhen’s place in the history of Chinese philosophy focus on his contributions to the ongoing dispute about the ontological status of li (pattern, principle) and qi (vital energy, material force), the two things most often proposed as the fundamental constituents of the universe in later Confucian metaphysics. Neo-Confucians such as Zhu Xi were arguably dualists about li and qi, acknowledging that the two could not exist apart from one another, but also seeing them as mutually irreducible. By contrast, Dai’s treatises seek to explain away the phenomena and the canonical terminology that strike so many of his predecessors as referencing irreducible notions of li, often by recasting them as references to the cyclical movements of yin and yang, or as particular arrangements of emotions or material bodies—all of these being typically understood as qi-based phenomena. Dai never declares himself a monist about qiin any unambiguous way,but he nevertheless devotes himself to showing how conceptions of the former should be explained in terms of the latter, and he is now frequently cited for the philological ingenuity and argumentative creativity that he brought to bear against Zhu Xi’s dualism.

As the great synthesizer of Neo-Confucian thought, Zhu Xi understands li as the cosmological patterns or principles that both make a thing the kind of thing it is (e.g., a human being rather than a goat) and determine the norms to which a thing should conform (e.g., serving one’s family, being of sound mind, and so on). Proper accounts of a thing’s kind and its norms should, Zhu believes, ultimately appeal to these patterns, not to the endowment of qi—the stuff that makes up one’s body and embodied feelings and desires—that a thing happens to have. Zhu understands li both as patterns that belong to the cosmos as a whole and, as Dai is fond of pointing out, as formless things that somehow exist inside all concrete individuals, including the heart-and-mind of every human being. These internalized li are, for Zhu, the “parts” or “manifestations” (fen) of the cosmological li, which implies in turn that the patterns belonging to each concrete individual are produced by (and thus harmonize with) the patterns that govern Heaven and Earth.

Dai Zhen’s trenchant criticism of the metaphysical picture offered by Zhu and other Neo-Confucians is that they wrongly took li and qi to be “two roots” (er ben)—that is, they mistakenly saw li as being “rooted” separately from qi (ch. 19). This critique encapsulates two general sorts of errors that he finds in the thought of his Neo-Confucian predecessors. The first is their tendency to see li as being separately “rooted” in the sense of having independent causal power. For example, Dai never embraces the view that the liare somehow responsible for making an individual thing the kind of thing it is. If li have anything to do with distinguishing between kinds, he maintains, it is simply because they represent the fine-grained features of things that we use to identify what kind they are, not the causal agent that makes them what they are (ch. 1). Similarly, he takes issue with the Neo-Confucian assertion that there is some li-based cosmological force that gives rise to qi’s tendency to fluctuate between two extremes (yin and yang). For Dai, the term for this purported cosmological force, known from the Classic of Change as “extreme polarity” or “taiji,” simply describes or names the fundamental oscillation in the cosmic qi. It is not a distinct force that makes the qi move as it does (ch. 18).

The second sense in which Dai’s predecessors see li as separately “rooted” is in conceiving of it as having independent explanatory power, such that one could give an adequate account of li without appealing to qi. The consequences of this sort of error are most apparent in moral claims. For Zhu Xi, to say that someone’s behavior is virtuous or good is to say that it is a proper expression of the li in her, which means in turn that it is a proper expression of some natural endowment of patterning imbued in her heart-and-mind by Heaven. Dai sees this as the wrong sort of story to tell, not just because it presupposes the existence of an unlikely causal agent (the formless “li” of the individual heart-and-mind), nor because he rejects the view that our Heavenly-endowed nature is predisposed in some small way to recognize and delight in the good (in fact, Dai seems to accept some version of this picture). Rather, Dai sees it as mistaken because it has nothing to do with why such behavior is good. Dai’s own preferred account invokes not the proclivities of Heaven as a basis for moral claims, but instead the proper arrangement of such worldly qi-based things as emotional dispositions and desires. Things are in accordance with their proper patterns, Dai asserts, when “the feelings do not err” (ch. 2).

Ever the attentive classicist, Dai traces much of the confusion he finds in the Neo-Confucian usage of “li” to a subtle misreading of the Confucian canon. In the Confucian classics, Dai notes, when the term “li” is used in its moral sense it tends to refer to the state of things when they are patterned in the right way, or “well-ordered” (tiao li) (ch. 1). Thus to speak of the “li” of something (e.g., a person, a boat) is not to refer to some formless object in that thing, but simply to the perfected state of that thing. The Neo-Confucians run afoul of this original sense of the word in assuming that “li” must denote something like an actual object, existing in esse. In so doing, Dai suggests, they open the door to a very different explanation of how someone becomes a “li” or “well-ordered” version of herself, where what makes her well-ordered is not simply that she has improved upon her feelings and desires in the right way, but that some quasi-object in her has expressed itself in the right way. For Dai, in contrast, it is enough to think of li as the state of things as they ought to be:

The exhaustive grasp of human li is nothing but an exhaustive grasp of what is imperative (biran) in human relations and daily affairs, and that is all. “What is imperative” is to push something to its greatest limit, where it can no longer be altered, and this is to speak of its perfection, not to trace out its root. (ch. 13)

5. Influence

At the time of Dai Zhen’s death he was widely revered for his scholarship in such fields as mathematics and phonology but ignored or dismissed as a philosopher. Among his contemporaries, the best-known admirers of his work on metaphysics and ethics were Hong Bang (1745-1779) and Zhang Xuecheng (1738-1801), though their admiration had little impact on other scholars of the era. Dai’s most successful student and friend, Duan Yucai (1735-1815), wrote a biography of Dai in which he dutifully reported his teacher’s profound devotion to and enthusiasm for his less popular philosophical works. But Duan never shared that enthusiasm and himself worked on conventional philological issues.

Only in the late nineteenth and early twentieth century were Dai’s On the Good and Evidential Study taken up with much interest, notably by reform-minded thinkers such as Zhang Taiyan (1868-1936), Liu Shipei (1884-1919), and Liang Qichao (1873-1929), who were particularly drawn to Dai’s suggestion that Cheng-Zhu thought countenanced abuses of power unchecked by the feelings and desires of the disadvantaged or powerless. Later, with the rise of Marxist thought in China, Dai’s attack on Neo-Confucian li—and his concomitant interest in explaining phenomena in terms of qi—made his work a convenient centerpiece for sweeping narratives about the decline of “idealism” and rise of “materialism” in the Ming and Qing dynasties. To some extent this preoccupation with Dai’s place in the li-qi debate lingers in the literature today, although scholars have increasingly turned to focus on his moral philosophy in its own right. Throughout the last two centuries, Dai has remained one of the chief sources of inspiration to those Confucian scholars who find Song and Ming Confucianism to be unviable or fundamentally contaminated with Daoist and Buddhist concepts. As such, he continues to be regarded as one of the most prominent internal critics of the Confucian tradition today.

6. References and Further Reading

Although the study of Dai Zhen’s life and work has become a minor cultural industry in the last couple of decades, there is still relatively little published material that focuses primarily on his philosophy, and even less that is accessible to those unfamiliar with the exegetical disputes prominent in his day. Readers are encouraged to begin with Feng Youlan and Philip J. Ivanhoe (below), and to make use of general surveys of the history of Chinese philosophy.

Chin, Ann-ping, and Freeman, Mansfield. Tai Chen [Dai Zhen] on Mencius: Explorations in Words and Meanings. New Haven: Yale University Press, 1990.
- A widely available summary of Dai’s life and thought, with a complete if not always careful translation of Dai’s most important philosophical work, the Evidential Study.
Ewell, John W. Reinventing the Way: Dai Zhen’s Evidential Commentary on the Meanings of Terms in Mencius (1777). Berkeley: Ph.D. dissertation in history, 1990.
- Includes the strongest of the available English translations of Dai’s Evidential Study.
Feng Youlan [Fung Yu-lan]. A History of Chinese Philosophy,volume II. Trans. Derk Bodde. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1953.
- An English translation of this well-known scholar’s monumental survey of history of Chinese philosophy. The portion devoted to Dai Zhen is replete with ample quotations from Dai’s works.
Hu Shi. Dai Dongyuan de zhexue (The Philosophy of Dai Dongyuan). Reprinted in Taipei: Taiwan Shangwu, 1996.
- An important and thorough if somewhat dated introduction to Dai Zhen’s philosophy and his place in Qing dynasty academics. This edition also includes the full texts of Dai’s On the Goodand Evidential Study,as well as several of his letters.
Ivanhoe, Philip J. “Dai Zhen.” In Confucian Moral Self Cultivation, 2^nd ed. (Indianapolis, IN: Hackett Publishing Company, 2000): 89-99.
- The best introduction to Dai Zhen’s moral thought in the English language. This work also exhibits the rare virtue (in Dai Zhen studies) of being accessible to those less familiar with classical Chinese language and Neo-Confucianism.
Lao Siguang. Xin bian zhong guo zhe xue shi (History of Chinese Philosophy, new edition). Taipei : San min shu ju, 1981.
- A view of Dai Zhen from one of his more strident critics, presented as the final chapter of a survey of Chinese philosophy. Lao uses little charity in attempting to understand Dai, but his is one of the very few lengthy studies that focuses primarily on the philosophical content of Dai’s views.
Nivison, David S. “Two Kinds of ‘Naturalism’: Dai Zhen and Zhang Xuecheng.” In The Ways of Confucianism: Investigations in Chinese Philosophy, ed. Bryan Van Norden (Chicago: Open Court, 1996): 261-82.
- Nivison’s contribution to the academic “cottage industry” in studies of Dai’s influence on Zhang. Like most such studies, this piece is primarily an exercise in intellectual history, but Nivison’s passing summaries of Dai’s views are careful and insightful.
Shun, Kwong-loi. “Mencius, Xunzi, and Dai Zhen: A Study of the Mengzi ziyi shuzheng.” In Mencius: Contexts and Interpretations, ed. Alan K. L. Chan (Honolulu: University of Hawaii Press, 2002): 216-241.
- An overview of Dai Zhen’s masterwork. This piece is particularly helpful in sorting out Dai’s several ways of understanding the doctrine that human nature is good.
Tiwald, Justin. “Dai Zhen on Human Nature and Moral Cultivation.” In the Dao Companion to Neo-Confucian Philosophy, ed. John Makeham (Dordrecht [Netherlands]: Springer, 2009): Ch. 20.
- An extended overview and analysis of Dai’s ethics.
Yu Yingshi. Lun Dai Zhen yu Zhang Xuecheng (On Dai Zhen and Zhang Xuecheng). Taipei: Dong da tu shu gu fen you xian gong si, 1996.
- Originally published in 1976, this is one of the best Chinese language works on Dai Zhen’s philosophical life and writings, although the focus is on Dai’s influence on Zhang Xuecheng and Qing dynasty academics.

Author Information

Justin Tiwald
Email: jtiwald@sfsu.edu
San Francisco State University
U. S. A.

Benedict de Spinoza: Epistemology

spinoza The theory of knowledge, or epistemology, offered by the 17^th century Dutch philosopher Benedict de Spinoza may yet prove to be the most daring in the history of philosophy. Not only does Spinoza claim to be able to know all the ways one can know something, he also claims to be able to know what everything is. Few philosophers besides Spinoza have sought and proclaimed possession of absolute knowledge quite like he had. Of the philosophers who have claimed absolute knowledge, only Spinoza has offered it, not as the reception of a divine revelation, and not as the fulfillment of a historical process, as in Hegel’s epistemology, but as a means for intuitively affirming the truth inherent within all of reality. Reality is susceptible to such an intuition, he said, because every being is a mode of it, or a way that it expresses itself. In other words, for us to come to know the “absolute” is for the absolute to come to know itself. There is thus something basically self-reflexive and introspective about Spinoza’s epistemology. At the same time, knowledge for Spinoza is always of what he calls God or Nature, which can also be understood as the universe itself.

However, whether or not Spinoza’s epistemology is valid by any standard besides his own, remains a point of contention. Most philosophers believe that Spinoza’s epistemology wildly oversteps the limits of human finitude, while others believe that even if Spinoza certainly experienced something within himself that he called “the truth,” we have no real access to it ourselves. This article explores the role and function of knowledge in Spinoza’s philosophy as a whole and the methodology he uses to know things and to know knowledge. The article closely follows Spinoza’s threefold division of the different types of knowledge as presented in his Ethics. This threefold division is constituted by the distinctions among imagination, intuition, and the exercise of the intellect.

The Role of Knowledge in Spinoza’s Philosophy
1. Why Search for Knowledge?
2. Knowledge in the Ethics
Spinoza’s Method for Epistemology
1. The Geometric Method
2. The Sub Specie Model, or Perspectivism
The First Kind of Knowledge
The Second Kind of Knowledge
The Third Kind of Knowledge
1. Intuition
2. Love and Blessedness
References and Further Reading

1. The Role of Knowledge in Spinoza’s Philosophy

Spinoza’s philosophy as a whole can be seen as continuous reflection on the role and function of knowledge itself. As a rationalist, along with Descartes and Leibniz, he was concerned with improving the power of the intellect, with its inherent capacity to reason, so that it could overcome the obscurity and confusion of our everyday perceptions. Spinoza’s first attempt at writing philosophy was a treatise intended to teach us how to best utilize our natural, rational powers so as to overcome our enslavement to the partial knowledge supplied by the senses. This work was the Treatise on the Emendation of the Intellect (TdIE). Spinoza wrote this work, it is believed, in the early 1660s, but he never finished it. In the treatise, Spinoza begins with an autobiographical moment that explains to the reader why he wanted to improve or emend the intellect.

1a. Why Search for Knowledge?

Spinoza sees the obtaining of true knowledge to be the sole avenue for liberating oneself from the limits and fallibility of an average human existence. Both for the mind and the body, Spinoza is searching for a way we can come to correct ourselves and thus know reality with a certainty that would guarantee for us a thoroughly active and affirmative existence, which is an existence defined solely by the active affects of joy and love. There is, therefore, also an ethical aspect to the improvement of the mind that a search for true knowledge is intended to yield. Spinoza calls the joy which a true knowledge of things would imply the “true good.” Such a “true good” is not merely an ephemeral happiness, but instead an eternal joy. Spinoza writes:

After experience had taught me that all the things which regularly occur in ordinary life are empty and futile, and I saw that all the things which were the cause or object of my fear had nothing of good or bad in themselves, except insofar as [my] mind was moved by them, I resolved at last to try to find out whether there was anything which would be the true good, capable of communicating itself, and which alone would affect the mind, all others being rejected—whether there was something which, once found and acquired, would continuously give me the greatest joy, to eternity (TdIE 1).

Spinoza does not deny that searching for true knowledge is a risky gesture. To sacrifice the pleasantries and safety of what everyday experience provides and proclaims as certain is to risk interrupting the comfort of one’s normal routine. In light of this, Spinoza sought to search for true knowledge in a way that would not violate the comfort of his everyday existence, but that would reject what humans usually take to be the highest goods: “riches, honor, and sensual pleasure” (TdIE 3). What this means is that true knowledge will not make you money, give you a popular reputation, or even offer you any momentary delights. Spinoza’s own biography attends to this fact. However, Spinoza was no ascetic. For him, true knowledge does not consist in any misanthropic disavowal of the plight of human beings. Rather, obtaining true knowledge will simply allow one to live with the internal confidence that existence is not defined merely by the indefinite search for finite pleasures. True knowledge will instead empower its possessor to the extent that s/he will be unperturbed by the vacillating conflict of the emotions, or affects, that determine the everyday existence of most humans. In this sense, Spinoza’s emphasis on the affective power of true knowledge is very similar to Stoicism. Ultimately, we should search for true knowledge not only because it will improve our inherent rational ability to check and control our reactive and passive emotions and drives, but because true knowledge will lead us to a direct experience of the essence of all reality, which is an experience that liberates us from finite concerns and endows us with the power and virtue of true blessedness. For Spinoza, true blessedness is an expression of intellectual love towards an eternal and infinite entity: God or Nature. We should search for true knowledge because it will allow us to become truly blessed and wise. Wisdom is true blessedness, or beatitude, for Spinoza. To emend the intellect so that it can use its reason to control its emotions will also allow it, along with becoming wise, to discover the true laws of Nature and common properties of all things. Checking its natural tendency toward reactive passivity and confused perceptions is the self-cultivation of a power essential to the intellect. An emended intellect is, therefore, the perfection of a way of knowing and existing that has searched for and obtained true knowledge.

1b. Knowledge in the Ethics

The most mature statement of Spinoza’s philosophy is his Ethics. The Ethics is composed of five parts. The first part gives us Spinoza’s ontology. It deals primarily with what Spinoza regards to be the one true substance or thing that defines reality, which is, once again, God or Nature. Spinoza felt that, prior to discovering how one can know anything, it was best to start any philosophic investigation by establishing the very nature of what is. Getting to God as quickly as possible was only almost an injunction for Spinoza. Spinoza was a substance monist, which means he thought that everything is essentially one thing or substance and that all things are so many modes or ways it modifies or affects itself. The one substance that is everything is infinitely self-causing, self-expressing, and self-sustaining. It is all-powerful, perfect, and real. There is thus only one substance in Nature, as opposed to the many substances philosophers from Aristotle to Descartes had presumed, and that substance is Nature itself. Substance is an indivisible entity of which everything is a modification. The essence of substance, which is its eternal and necessary existence, is what Spinoza calls the attributes. While there is in essence an absolute and indivisible infinity of attributes, we know only two of these attributes: thought and extension. We can know thought and extension because we are ourselves modes of them. Thought is an infinite power of thinking that is God’s idea of himself, while we, our minds and all our thoughts, are so many ways God modifies himself by constitutively expressing himself through an indefinite amount of finite thoughts. In other words, God has and is every idea, while we are just our idea of our ideas of our body and the other bodies that affect us. Extension, likewise, is an infinite power of acting that is God’s infinite and self-causal body (for he is Nature and Nature is essentially physical), while we, our bodies and all the bodies that compose and affect us, are so many ways God modifies himself by constitutively expressing himself through an indefinite amount of finite bodies. In other words, God has and is every body—he is Nature’s naturing (natura naturans)—while we are just our body’s drive to persevere as it intends to actively make stronger compositions with other bodies.

The second part of the Ethics is about the human mind and how it has the ability to emend itself so it can come to know not only its own essence as a finite thing, but also the infinite essence of which it is a mode. The second part teaches us how we can come to know how we are a way God infinitely expresses and continuously causes himself to exist, which is to say we can come to know God’s attributes. We will deal with this part of the Ethics extensively in the sections to come. If the second part teaches us how to strengthen our minds so we can come to know what we really are and how we actually exist as thinking things, then the next two parts of the Ethics (the third dealing with the affects and the fourth their strength) teaches us how to strengthen our bodies so we can come to physically be what we really are and how we actually exist as extended things essentially defined by a desire to persevere. The fifth and final part of the Ethics, dealing with Spinoza’s definition of freedom, synthesizes these approaches and teaches us how to immediately intuit and affirm the infinite and eternal essence we had come to know and embody through the prior parts. The role of knowledge in the Ethics is, therefore, both essential and integral. Through an improvement of our knowledge we can come to be strong and free, or wise and blessed. Spinoza’s understanding and use of knowledge in the Ethics is presented as a way for giving us the means to discover not only the different ways we can know reality, but also the best way we can know it. The ultimate goal of showing us what knowledge is and how we can render it truer—thereby emboldening it with a certain adequacy, power, and clarity and distinctness—is to enable us to obtain that eternal joy which is the very reason why we search for true knowledge in the first place. The role and function of knowledge in the Ethics is to be that way through which we can come to adequately, actively, and rationally exist.

2. Spinoza’s Method for Epistemology

Implied in Spinoza’s epistemology is the admission that there are a variety of ways one can have knowledge. It is also implied in Spinoza epistemology that there is a definitively adequate way for knowing this variety of ways. Spinoza’s method for his epistemology has two aspects, one that is formal and another that is more concerned with the concrete perspectives that define the different ways one can have knowledge.

2a. The Geometric Method

It might appear strange that Spinoza waits until part II of the Ethics to address the human mind and the different ways it can have knowledge, considering that the search for the freedom and blessedness of true knowledge is the stated purpose of his thinking. The reason he does this is because of the structural demands of the form in which he wrote the Ethics. Spinoza writes the Ethics in geometric form, which entails that in each part of the text the formal presentation of his arguments involve the use of definitions, axioms, propositions, demonstrations, proofs, scholia, and so on. Formally, the Ethics is written in a way that is similar to Euclid’s Elements. Also, Descartes had popularized the use of geometric form in Spinoza’s time. In opposition to Descartes, however, Spinoza preferred a more synthetic geometric approach than an analytic one. Synthesis is a way of combining primary or axiomatic truths already established as indubitable or self-evident in order to reach other primary truths. To utilize a synthetic geometric method allows one to start with certain ultimate conclusions or truths in order to build a new knowledge from them by demonstrating and proving propositions on their basis. This is why Spinoza starts with God, the one substance that is everything. There are things about God or Nature that simply cannot be denied and that must serve as the basis from which all other knowledge will be derived: that he essentially exists, that he is absolutely infinite, self-causal, conceivable as existing only in and through himself, omnipotent, omniscient, and eternally existing of necessity.

So, in a sense, Spinoza already has absolute knowledge before he reaches it. While the synthetic geometric method was that powerful for him, Spinoza also knew that we, as readers, still needed to progress through the entirety of his text in order to see if and how he was right. Believing that what Spinoza establishes as axiomatically certain is in fact so is a necessary gesture on our part if we are to come to know how Spinoza can start with such perfect knowledge. In other words, Spinoza writes the rest of his Ethics for a reason when he could have just as easily cut everything off after part I, and that reason is that he wants to teach us what we, quite paradoxically, already know as well. The knowledge we all already have is what Spinoza himself explicitly knows as he put it into axiomatic form. The process of coming to have knowledge, for Spinoza, is thus always an explication of a knowledge that is eternally implied in every mind. Spinoza uses the axiomatic geometric form so he does not have to waist time by starting from scratch and eventually discovering the very basis from which he can start through the simple establishment of definitions and axioms. This can be seen as the reason why he never completed the TdIE as well, because it began with the natural inadequacy of our everyday knowledge and sought to overcome it through an almost analytic process of forming a basis from which future knowledge would be capable of discovering the very truth of God that Spinoza and, according to him, we all already know. Such an analytic approach was Descartes’ in his Meditations and it was also probably the main inspiration for Spinoza’s writing the TdIE in the way that he did. By beginning with God and what is absolutely true of him in the Ethics, Spinoza could then show us the variety of ways in which we are inherently both inadequately and adequately knowing God from the start. Spinoza found the destructive tendencies of the analytic method, especially of Descartes’ hyperbolic doubt, to be superfluous because if one has the truth it is not doubted and if it is doubted then it is not the truth and you do not have it.

For Spinoza, it is not that we do not have knowledge of God. The problem is that our knowledge is usually quite poor and confused. But merely by following Spinoza through the Ethics, because of its synthetic geometric form, we come to know that we already have a knowledge that is, in an everyday sense, quite poor. The way to come to know adequately then what we always already know inadequately is to come to know the different ways that knowledge can be known and the different ways knowledge knows things, both of which will become utterly identical through the reflexivity demanded by Spinoza’s epistemology. Such reflexivity, therefore, will constitute Spinoza’s actual method for doing epistemology insofar as the geometric method is the formal presentation of its synthetic necessities, but not its precise application to the different kinds of knowledge. Spinoza says as much in the TdIE when he argues that any true method must be “reflexive knowledge” (TdIE 38). This is not to say that Spinoza’s geometric method does not itself imply reflexivity, but that it is more the form in which a truly reflexive epistemology can be invented and utilized.

2b. The Sub Specie Model, or Perspectivism

The truly reflexive way Spinoza does epistemology can be called the sub specie model. Sub specie is Latin for “under the species or aspect of,” or “from the perspective of.” Each aspect or perspective of knowledge is a way of knowing. Spinoza uses the phrase when speaking of how, when we use the common notions and reason that define the second kind of knowledge, we perceive reality “under a certain species of eternity” (EIIP44C2). True knowledge for Spinoza, as we will see, means that one shifts one’s perspective away from imagining reality in terms of the abstractions and quantifications implied by using time (and space) to measure an indefinitely enduring finite existence, to intellectually conceiving reality from the perspective of its own true and indivisible eternity. Insofar as there is only one substance, one real thing, in and as the universe for Spinoza, when we have any knowledge, whether it is true or false, it is necessarily going to be of this substance. The sub specie model states that all the ways of knowing are different ways of knowing one thing and not different ways of knowing substantially different things. Each way of knowing is a perspective on one substance. While our knowledge may be perceived as changing, what we know cannot be truly perceived in such a way.

The sub specie model is reflexive because it allows Spinoza to know how knowledge actually functions while still sustaining his substance monism. He retains his substance monism by affirming the existence of the great variety of ways humans, and moreover all beings, can have knowledge as being so many ways God expresses himself. If all ways of knowing are ways God is known, then God himself, insofar as he is absolutely self-causal and self-expressive, would have to thereby know himself through and as all the different ways he is known. Therefore, from the perspective of God, God knows himself in an infinity of ways, while we, in our everyday existence and from our finite perspective, are just so many of these infinite ways God can both inadequately and adequately know all of reality as himself. But, does this mean that God is actually false as he knows himself inadequately through us? Yes, but only from a finite, limited, and inadequate perspective. On the other hand, while God essentially is the way we know him naturally and inadequately, he is also the adequate knowledge of our inadequate knowledge insofar as he absolutely knows all the ways he is known; or more precisely, he adequately knows himself in every way, from every perspective, he is known. God’s knowledge, therefore, is the absolutely self-reflexive epistemological model we must try to express, experience, embody, intuit, and know if we are to come to have true knowledge ourselves. In other words, we must become as epistemologically self-reflexive as God; that is, we must come to know our inadequate knowledge in the exact way or from the very perspective God adequately knows it.

To come to have adequate or true knowledge is first to come to know how our everyday, finite knowledge is just a way, a particular perspective, of having knowledge and that it is a perspective on God just like every other way of knowing. For us to have an adequately reflexive knowledge is for us to have a reflexive knowledge of God’s reflexive knowledge. That is, we must think God from his own absolutely self-reflexive, self-knowing perspective in order to have adequate knowledge, an adequate knowledge that is both of God and ourselves. For Spinoza, to have an adequate knowledge of epistemology, or adequate knowledge of the ways knowledge knows and is known, is to have an adequate epistemology of epistemology itself. Yet, we must now see how we can arrive at such knowledge. Now we must see the three main ways humans can have knowledge and how we can come to have God’s absolute knowledge of these ways from the absolute perspective he has on himself. We must see how we can shift our perspective to that of God’s absolute perspectivism. We must come to know how we can know reality sub specie aeternitatis.

3. The First Kind of Knowledge

Spinoza defines the first kind of knowledge as the lowest or most inadequate kind. It is also the natural way humans have knowledge. The first kind of knowledge is humanity’s perspective on reality. Spinoza, echoing Parmenides’ [https://iep.utm.edu/parmenid/] distinction between aletheia, or truth, and doxa, calls it opinion. The first kind of knowledge is also the only source of falsity (EIIP41).

3a. Imagination

For Spinoza, the human being is a singular thing, which means that it has a finite and determined existence (IID7). From one perspective, the human is a mind or thinking thing (IIA2). The human mind both has ideas and is itself an idea. From another perspective, the human is also an extended thing, or a finite and determined body. The human body is both composed of a great many bodies and is affected by a great many other bodies. The human mind and all its thoughts think nothing but the human body, the bodies that go to compose it, and the bodies that affect it (IIP12, 13). The human mind is the idea of the human body and it involves and expresses through all of its ideas all the bodies that compose its body and all the bodies that cause, affect, and determine it. The mind, in its naturally determined singularity, thinks nothing but its body’s affections. Affections are the states or conditions of a body’s reaction to another body’s affecting it. They are the ways both how our body reacts to being affected and how our mind thinks such reactions. From the perspective of the body, affections are usually expressions of receptivity, reactivity, passivity, and weakening on the part of the affected body. Affections are also feelings. Spinoza defines affections in terms of the physical affects, which are the ways the body becomes either stronger or weaker, or more joyful or sad (IIID3). Usually, one’s affections enslave one to a passive existence defined by a diminishing of one’s drive to persevere through forming greater and stronger compositions with other stronger bodies. From the perspective of the mind, affections are images of its affected body (and its increase or decrease in active power or freedom) and the bodies that affect it. Even though affections are things reactively received, they are also those thoughts through which the mind can posit as present the actual existence of its own affected body and all the bodies that affect it. As images, affections are still, even while passively received, essentially positive. Spinoza writes, “the affections of the human body whose ideas present external bodies as present to us, we shall call images of things…and when the mind regards bodies in this way, we shall say that it imagines” (IIP17S).

Now, for Spinoza, the human mind has knowledge of the singular existence of any body insofar as it imagines it. The problem, however, is that any knowledge based on passive affections, or images, is a partial, confused, mutilated (or fragmented), and inadequate knowledge. “Insofar as the human mind imagines an external body, it does not have an adequate knowledge of it” (IIP26C). Any idea, which is itself also an image, of an affection that is an image of an affected or affecting body inadequately expresses the true nature of such bodies. An image is inadequate, an inadequate idea, because it expresses only a confused and mutilated understanding of how a body affects another and what a body essentially is as a self-causal and affecting entity. For a body to imagine other bodies as actively, affectively, and causally determining the form of its existence is for a body to betray its own very minimal ability to be active, affective, and causal itself. Imagination is, therefore, submission to external determination. Through the imagination, a singular mind and body is defined solely by how other bodies determine its existence. The inadequacy of imagining is an expression of mental and physical weakness, for it is only a partial explanation of how bodies are essentially active and self-causally striving for an enhanced perseverance. An inadequate knowledge—a knowledge that merely posits as presently existing externally affective bodies and one’s own passively affected body—is a weak knowledge and, for Spinoza, is thus the very definition of falsity.

As long as I am merely receiving my affections and passively imagining the bodies that affect me, I express an inadequate and false knowledge of things. As long as I merely imagine bodies, I am not internally self-determining and explicitly expressive of the truly self-causal and active essence of all things and myself. Images are like the scars or traces bodies leave on me as they batter me because of my mental and physical sadness and weakness. Images are “like conclusions without premises” (IIP28D). By merely imagining bodies, I am enslaved to the common order of Nature, with its incessantly active, functioning, and self-causally moving bodies. By being so enslaved I understand Nature’s common order not in its inherently intellectual rationality, but rather as the fortuitous run of circumstance one endures through casual, vague, and random experiences (IIP40S2). It is important to emphasize, however, that the positivity implicit in false ideas cannot be the cause of their falsity, and that falsity does not involve a total privation of knowledge. Images are not non-beings devoid of all expressive content. Falsity is still an expression of the fact that all singular things exist; it is just that it is the weakest way of knowing this fact. In other words, inadequacy is the lowest degree of actual and active knowing and existing for Spinoza. Falsity is the poorest way of knowing God or Nature, that is, the poorest way it knows itself.

Spinoza defines a few other characteristics of the falsity of the first kind of knowledge. Affections, or images, are the sensations through which singular beings think and feel their externally determined bodies. Knowledge that stems entirely from sense perception is inadequate and false. Sense perception also defines a kind of knowing that forms only fictitious ideas of things (TdIE 52-56). These fictions are uncertain ideas of what constitutes the essential and necessary existence of things. Knowledge of the first kind is also knowledge based on signs and hearsay (TdIE 19). Signs and hearsay, along with all knowledge based on memory, give us knowledge of “almost everything that is of practical use in life” (TdIE 20). The good and common sense that makes everyday experiences and relations possible involve neither the clarity and distinctness nor the internal and self-causal adequacy that the truth requires. Instead, an everyday human existence is defined by a collective opining on the part of a multitude of singular beings that do not have the rational strength to overcome their enslavement to partially expressing through fragmented and confused ideas their passivity and externally determined existence.

3b. Prejudice and Superstition

One of Spinoza’s favorite examples of falsity is the illusion of free will that is so often propagated by the mutilated imagination of human beings. It is a natural prejudice of humans to assume they have liberty. Spinoza writes, “men are deceived in that they think themselves free [i.e., they think that, of their own free will, they can either do a thing or forbear doing it], an opinion which consists only in this, that they are conscious of their actions and ignorant of the causes by which they are determined” (EIIP35S). Humans imagine they get to make choices because their knowledge is an inadequate expression of what actually determines them to do everything they do, which includes them imagining they have free will. Spinoza is a thinker of determinism and necessitarianism. Humans are necessarily determined to be prejudicial and not know why or how. It is natural law, for Spinoza, that “men are born ignorant of the causes of things” (IApp). Spinoza next notes that humans often turn their prejudicial assumption of free will into the dogma of divine choice. Humans take their imaginary freedom based on contingency and possibility and apply it to a transcendent creator of the entire universe. The human image of God is of a being with an omnipotent reservoir of choices. Because humans find such an image staggering they are terrified they may choose something (namely, a form of worship) that God either has not himself chosen or that he has deemed to be morally reprehensible. Humans thus allow their prejudicial free will to congeal into a superstitious obsession with the impenetrable and inexhaustible free will of God (IApp). All of this is grossly inadequate and false, for Spinoza, for it merely doubles the error of free will and enslaves singular beings to an almost complete irrationality.

3c. Miracles, Prophecy, and Revelation

Another example of falsity that Spinoza gives is an extension of prejudice and superstition. It is the religious instinct to believe in the miraculous and prophetic, both of which depend upon the imagined reception of the revelation of God’s free choices. In the case of miracles, the necessity of natural laws is broken by an ultimately unknowable divine decision (TTP, 6). Once again, humans explain away their ignorance of the causes that determine them by imagining a substantial interruption in the natural order of things. While a miracle is imagined to provide humans with what they perceive to be an advantage, an omen is the negative counterpart to a miracle, but it still expresses the same falsity. Certain types of humans take advantage, for political purposes, of the inadequacy of the prejudicial and superstitious nature of those who are susceptible to believing in miracles and omens—that is, the multitude—by declaring their own ability to receive directly the revelation of the immediate results of God’s choices and commands. These beings are prophets and priests, and prophecy for Spinoza is nothing but a clever way of exploiting and disciplining the multitude through the use of an agile and vivid imagination (TTP, 1). For Spinoza, “revelation has occurred through images alone” (TTP, 1), which means that all religions based on revelation are essentially false. Revelation is an utterly inadequate and inappropriate way of understanding God.

4. The Second Kind of Knowledge

In light of the passive and inadequate state of our everyday knowledge and existence, beset as we are by an external determination of our singular existence by all the bodies we confusedly imagine as affecting us, Spinoza aims to establish the ways in which we can overcome our falsity and weakness and come to have an adequate and active knowledge. The first step to becoming adequate for Spinoza is for one to actively and reflexively shift one’s perspective away from the imagination to that of the rational powers inherent to the intellect. This self-activation of the intellect occurs through the formation of common notions, which are concepts that express the universal properties of all things.

4a. Intellection

Spinoza never supplied a clear-cut definition of the intellect. He appears to offer three different kinds of intellects. One is simply our finite mind. Another is the immediately caused and infinite in kind modal intellect that is common to and shared by all finite intellects. And there is a third kind of intellect that is God’s absolutely infinite and indivisibly self-causal thinking of himself, or the attribute of thought itself that goes to define God’s essential existence. These three intellects are implicit in each other as they are taken from their own explicit perspectives. From the explicit perspective of the finite intellect, for example, the imagination constitutes the vast majority of one’s thoughts, even though, Spinoza argues, implicit to a finite thinking is the infinite in kind thinking of which it is a part and the indivisibly infinite thinking it truly and essentially is. In order to emend our finite intellect so that it is no longer enslaved to imagining, but instead conceives what is implicit to its thinking, Spinoza shows us how to reflect upon the very nature of our minds and find what it is about it that we know with a fair degree of certainty. By reflecting upon our imagination we cannot but notice that imagining is the way we necessarily think in our usual condition and that we, even prior to noting that we are necessarily imagining beings, also notice that we are necessarily things that think. It is through this reflection upon the natural necessity of the inadequacy of our thinking that we begin to affirm with a certain clarity and distinctness something essential about ourselves as thinking things and so shift our perspective away from only explicitly imagining. For Spinoza, it follows from the necessity of the order of Nature that human beings inadequately imagine all that affects them and thus also imagine all of what they think (EIIP36). But it is this very thought of the necessity of our being singular entities that inadequately imagine that activates the powers of our intellect. By intellectually affirming the natural necessity that we as imagining beings are determined from without and follow a natural order, we can thereby come to know and internally affirm our own essential necessity in light of this order. The activation of the finite intellect is also the self-ordering of the affections or images that usually constitute a finite mind. To intellectually order one’s affections in the way they are necessarily and naturally determined is to begin to know both the conditions for their being caused and what in fact causes them as so many modes that follow and flow from an infinite mode of God.

An active finite intellect is a mind that knows that it falsely imagines the bodies that affect it. But to know one’s falsity truly for Spinoza is for one to know the truth because the truth is the standard both of itself and falsity (IIP43S). By reflecting on such a slight enhancement of knowledge, a finite intellect can increase its activity even more by beginning to understand the necessity and natural order it now knows it follows, and now orders its affection in accordance with, as being something of which it is a part and mode. For a mind, as it begins to actively conceive of its nature as a way Nature necessarily functions and follows from itself, it can begin to use its intellective capacities to know the essence of the infinite thinking that must be common to it and that it must be a way or mode of in order to be a thinking thing at all. For a body, as it begins to actively affect and determine the bodies that were formerly affecting and determining it, it can begin to compose greater composites of other bodies with these bodies it now determines and so strengthen its own essential activity and joy. In order for both the mind and the body to do this, what is common to all singular beings must be adequately known and conceived.

4b. Common Notions

Spinoza argues that what is common to all singular things cannot constitute the essence merely of one or an indefinite amount of particular things, but rather must be “equally in the part and the whole” (IIP37) of all singular things. This is because “those things which are common to all, and which are equally in the part and in the whole, can only be conceived adequately” (IIP38). The question is then, what is common to all singular things? If the intellect is activated through an affirmation of the necessity of the natural order of determinations it is a part of, it becomes even more active if it can conceive what all intellects must constitute as the entire or whole order of thinking itself. What is common to all finite intellects is an infinite intellect of which they are all modes and parts. For a finite intellect to conceive of the whole infinite intellect that it goes to compose, and thus is a way that it modifies itself, is for it to render its thinking adequate. The adequacy of conceiving what is common to all finite thinking is an expression of truth, or clarity and distinctness, for Spinoza.

All singularly thinking things agree in certain respects. One way they all agree is that they are all determined to imagine affections. Another is the simple fact that they all think. And another is that they all modify both an infinite in kind thinking, which is the inherent unity of all thinking as it is immediately caused by God, and also an indivisibly infinite thinking, which is God’s absolute thought of himself. All intellects are modes of an infinite intellect conceivable both as an immediately caused unity of finite intellects and an indivisible identity of all intellectual activity as being one absolutely infinite and eternally self-causal thinking. Spinoza argues that the common notion of the infinite intellect—from both its infinite in kind, immediately caused and indivisibly infinite, self-causal perspectives—is “common to all men” (IIP38C), which also means that it is inherent to the finite intellects of all singular beings. Every thinking thing cannot but implicitly think what is common to it, what it shares with other thinking things, what it is a part of, what it is essentially a unity of, and what it essentially is as a way God thinks himself. The process whereby a finite intellect thinks its inherent common notions is the active becoming of its explicit expression of the truth of all thinking things. The common notion the finite intellect adequately expresses as it becomes increasing active and self-determined is the clear and distinct idea of the immediate and infinite in kind intellect it modifies by being a part of it and the attribute of thought it modifies as an indivisible way God modifies itself.

There is another common notion implicit to an activated and adequate finite intellect, and it is a conception of what is common to all singular bodies. Insofar as all thoughts are actually the bodies and affections they think because of Spinoza’s doctrine of the parallel identity of thoughts and bodies, the common notions of the infinite intellect and the attribute of thought are also clear and distinct conceptions of the immediate and infinite in kind mode of extension and extension itself. It is of the nature of bodies first of all to be extended things. Secondly, it is of the nature of all extended things to indefinitely compose with and decompose each other. All bodies agree in that they are all each both parts of a larger whole and themselves wholes with parts. The fact that all bodies are alive for Spinoza leads this compositional structure of all bodies to be constantly in flux. Therefore, what is also common to all bodies, along with being extended composites, is the fact that they are all moving at different speeds. To be a singular body is to be an indefinitely composing and decomposing extended composite that speeds up or slows down (IIP13, Ep 32). Spinoza calls the immediate and infinite in kind mode of extension “motion and rest.” Motion and rest is the whole or unity of all bodies conceived as one individual body that is all the degrees of compositional movement. All singular bodies are modes of motion and rest, which is itself the immediate and infinite in kind mode of the indivisibly infinite and absolutely self-modifying attribute of extension, or what Spinoza calls Nature naturing (natura naturans). Motion and rest parallels the infinite in kind intellect, and both are in essence the attributes they immediately modify and follow from, which is God’s indivisibly self-causal essence.

4c. Reason

Spinoza next needs to show us how we can conceive of these common notions through our affections. For Spinoza, we are very affected. The more we are affected the more we think, but usually imagine, what affects us. But now we know how to adequately conceive of the true nature, the essential properties, of all singular things. Through common notions we can open ourselves up to a plethora of affections without becoming enslaved to them because of our reflexive and perspectival ability to know the necessity and intellectual order of all things, that is, to know all things either as ways an infinite intellect thinks or as ways the whole of Nature compositionally moves. To be active and affirmative toward one’s affections is to use reason to understand how they determine one to exist. But reason is not merely a calm reception of affections. Through an adequate conception and utilization of the reasoning power of the common notions one can become the active cause of all of what one is affected by. The power to be affectively causal in one’s own right is reason’s ability to make us truly free. True freedom, for Spinoza, is the affirmative following of divine or natural necessity. By being rational one can control and order all of one’s affections by conceiving what it truly common to what one is affected by and thus thinks. To open oneself up to an indefinite amount of affections, and yet still rationally control one’s reactions to them, is to actually compose with all such bodies by forming a greater, stronger, and more joyful whole. Through a rational use of the implicit truth and power of the common notions inherent to the intellect one can become the very means through which the unity, and even more the absolute indivisibility, of God or Nature can be intuitively affirmed and embodied through one’s own essential existence.

5. The Third Kind of Knowledge

If the truth and adequacy of the common notions activate our intellectual capacity to rationally control our emotions and causally determine the bodies around us to enter into greater and stronger compositions, thereby liberating us into the absolute necessity of God’s natural and lawful order, then it is the intuition, the intuitive knowledge and embodiment, of this truth that will make us eternally wise and blessed. Blessedness consists in loving God with the love whereby he loves himself (VP36), and to intellectually love God not only gives us a blessed existence, it also gives us eternal joy. With the third kind of knowledge, knowledge is solely sub specie aeternitatis.

5a. Intuition

Spinoza defines the third kind of knowledge as a “kind of knowing that proceeds from an adequate idea of the formal essence of certain attributes of God to the adequate knowledge of the [formal] essence of things” (IIP40S2). The second kind of knowledge supplies us with the adequate idea that all singular things must be unified into something immediately caused by God (the infinite in kind and immediate modes) and that all singular things are modes of certain attributes of God (thought and extension). With the third kind of knowledge we can know an attribute not merely through a common notion, but as the essential existence itself of God’s indivisible infinity and eternal necessity. The third kind of knowledge is the knowledge that knows the essence of each and every thing as a way that God causes himself to exist. Knowing a singular thing without the explicit mediation of knowing what it composes into or is as a part of an immediate causal order and connection, is to know it intuitively as simply being a way God eternally and infinitely exists. Intuition is intellectual knowledge taken beyond the immediacy of the infinite in kind. Intuition is more immediate than immediacy; it is affirmative identification, the absolutely self-reflexive identification and knowledge of God and his modes through oneself. Intuition is the absolute affirmation of the natural and necessary eternity of God’s attributes as essentially being the singular things he expresses of himself. Intuition is the knowledge that all things are one thing that God is, that all his attributes are the modes with which he modifies himself. We can know through the essence of singular things that the certain attributes they modify are also the indivisibility of all of God’s attributes, insofar as “no attribute of substance can be truly conceived from which it follows that substance can be divided” (IP12). Intuition is what allows us to know not merely the attributes we modify, but to know both ourselves as the attributes we modify and all the attributes themselves as being the essential existence of all things that is God. In other words, intuition allows us to know all the attributes as the ways God is one indivisible and absolutely immanent entity. Through an intuition of God’s essence one can know the infinity and eternity of one’s own mind and body. To shift one’s perspective to that of God’s is to conceive of the eternal aspect of all things and to intuitively see oneself through God’s absolute perfection and power.

5b. Love and Blessedness

For Spinoza, to intuit God is to love God. The intuition of God is the intellectual love of his essential existence, with love being that power of intuition that makes intellection (the exercise of the intellect) more immediate than the immediacy known through the common notions of the second kind of knowledge. Love is defined, on the one hand, as “joy with the accompanying idea of an external cause” (IIIP13S), but, on the other hand, with the intellectual love of God the idea of the cause of such joy is more an internal cause than an external one because through the third kind of knowledge one knows absolutely that God constitutes one’s own essential existence. In a finite sense, joy is an increase in perfection, but the joy involved in the intellectual love of God is almost an identification of one’s love with God’s very absolute perfection, or infinite self-love. God’s absolute self-love is his indivisibly infinite and eternal self-causal power to essentially exist as all things. The third kind of knowledge, intuitive knowledge, loves this self-love in the way that it loves itself. The intellectual love of God is the absolute knowledge of all the ways one can know God and all the ways God knows himself as an infinity of ways he conceives and loves his own truth for all eternity. It is with the aid of the affective power of reason that our liberation into true necessity is affirmed even more intensely as we come to embody the freedom to conceive of the universe from its own eternally living and infinitely natural perspective of absolute perfection, power, and reality.

The third kind of knowledge endows us with a kind of immortality. It is not that we exist in our perceived or imagined finite form for all eternity, because all finite bodies and the ideas and affections of them decompose, but that we exist eternally by shifting our perspective and our knowledge to that of the infinity and eternity of God’s indivisibly physical self-conception and self-knowledge (VP29). Spinoza writes, “Insofar as our mind knows itself and the body under a species of eternity, it necessarily has knowledge of God, and knows that it is in God and is conceived through God” (VP30). To intuit God through an intellectual love of his essential existence, and thereby conceive all things from his eternal perspective, is to render our adequate knowledge and rational freedom truly divine. Blessedness is the virtue, rarity, excellence, and power of our absolute knowledge of God’s absolute knowledge. Absolute knowledge is thus divine wisdom.

6. References and Further Reading

All passages from the texts of Spinoza are taken from the translations appearing in The Collected Works of Spinoza. Vol. I. Edited and translated by Edwin Curley. (Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1985). Passages from the Ethics are cited according to Book (I – V), Definition (D), Axiom (A), Proposition (P), Corollary (C), and Scholium (S). For example, (IVP13S) refers to Ethics, Book IV, Proposition 13, Scholium. Passages from the Treatise on the Emendation of the Intellect are cited according to paragraph number. For example, (TdIE 35) refers to Treatise on the Emendation of the Intellect, paragraph 35.

Curley, Edwin, “Experience in Spinoza’s Theory of Knowledge” in Spinoza: A Collection of Critical Essays, ed. Marjorie Grene, (Garden City, NY: Doubleday/Anchor Press, 1973), 25-59.
Curley, Edwin, Filippo Magnini, and W. N. A Klever (eds). Spinoza’s Epistemology, vol.2 of Studia Spinozana. (Hanover: Walther & Walther Verlag, 1986).
De Dijn, Herman. Spinoza: The Way to Wisdom. (West Lafayette, IN: Purdue University Press, 1996).
Deleuze, Gilles. Spinoza: Practical Philosophy. (San Francisco: City Lights Books, 1988).
Della Rocca, Michael. Representation and the Mind-Body Problem in Spinoza. (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1996).
Floistad, Guttorm, “Spinoza’s Theory of Knowledge in the Ethics” in Spinoza: A Collection of Critical Essays, ed. Marjorie Grene, (Garden City, NY: Doubleday/Anchor Press, 1973), 101-127.
Garret, Don, “Spinoza,” in A Companion to Epistemology, ed. Ernest Sosa and Jonathan Dancy, (Oxford: Basil Blackwell, 1992), 488-490.
Garrett, Don, “Representation and Consciousness in Spinoza’s Naturalistic Theory of the Imagination” in Interpreting Spinoza: Critical Essays, ed. Charlie Huenemann, (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2008), 4-25.
Huenemann, Charlie, “Epistemic Autonomy in Spinoza,” in Interpreting Spinoza: Critical Essays, ed. Charlie Huenemann, (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2008), 94-110.
Lloyd, Genevieve, Part of Nature: Self-Knowledge in Spinoza’s Ethics. (Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press, 1994).
Mark, Thomas Carson. Spinoza’s Theory of Truth. (New York: Columbia University Press, 1972).
Parkinson, G. H. R., Spinoza’s Theory of Knowledge. (Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1954).
Parkinson, G. H. R., “Language and Knowledge in Spinoza” in Spinoza: A Collection of Critical Essays, ed. Marjorie Grene, (Garden City, NY: Doubleday/Anchor Press, 1973), 73-100.
Wilson, Margaret D., “Spinoza’s Theory of Knowledge” in The Cambridge Companion to Spinoza, ed. Don Garrett, (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1996), 89-141.

Author Information

Nels Dockstader
Email: jdocksta@uwo.ca
The University of Western Ontario
Canada

Louise-Françoise de la Baume Le Blanc, marquise de La Vallière (1644—1710)

lavalliere A mistress of Louis XIV, who became a Carmelite nun, Mademoiselle de la Vallière has long fascinated historians and novelists by her picaresque life. But only recently has the philosophical dimension of that life received attention. During her years as royal mistress, La Vallière studied the works of Aristotle and Descartes in the literary salons of Paris. After her religious conversion under the direction of Bossuet, she composed a treatise dealing with the mercy of God. In this work and in her correspondence, La Vallière revealed her skill as a moraliste, a critic of the contradictions and subterfuges of the human psyche. Her writings focus in particular on virtue theory. La Vallière privileges the theological virtues of faith, hope, and charity; she criticizes the unredeemed cardinal virtues as masks of human pride. As a social critic, La Vallière demonstrates how the culture of the court has produced counterfeits of the theological virtues. Her writings insist on the necessary presence of grace for the emergence of authentic virtue, as well as express skepticism on the capacity of nature alone to cultivate virtue. Rather than being abolished, the human passions undergo their own conversion in the grace-induced dynamic of repentance and reform.

Biography
Works
Moral Philosophy
Reception and Interpretation
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources
2. Secondary Sources

1. Biography

On August 6, 1644, Louise-Françoise de la Baume Le Blanc de laVallière was born into an aristocratic family in Tours. Both parents claimed a distinguished lineage. Her father, Laurent, Seigneur de la Vallière, descended from a family noted for its military service to the French crown. At the time of his daughter’s birth, he held the post of governor of the royal chateau of Amboise. Descended from a noblesse de robe family known for its legal service to the throne, her mother, Françoise Le Prévost, was the widow of a prominent member of the parliament in Paris. After the death of Louise-Françoise’s father in 1651, Jacques de Courtavel, marquis de Saint Rémy, married her newly widowed mother. In the recurrent struggles between the absolutist French monarchy and the restive aristocracy attempting to maintain its ancient privileges, the members of the La Vallière family sided with the royalist cause.

Mademoiselle de la Vallière was raised in a militantly Catholic provincial aristocracy. Ecclesiastical vocations were common in her immediate family. Uncle Gilles was bishop of Nantes; Uncle Jacques was a Jesuit priest; Aunts Élisabeth and Charlotte were Ursuline nuns. La Vallière’s formal education was primarily literary. Under the tutelage of her Urusuline aunts, the young Louis-Françoise studied grammar, reading, composition, and public speaking. In 1655, she moved to the chateau of Blois for her adolescent education. The official residence of Gaston, duc d’Orléans, the brother of Louis XIII, Blois permitted La Vallière to join the Orléans daughters in the courses conducted by the house chaplain, Abbé de Rancé, a cultured theologian who would later emerge as one of France’s leading monastic reformers. In this royal curriculum, La Vallière studied the arts of painting, music, etiquette, and equitation as well as continuing her literary studies. Under the guidance of Rancé, she was introduced to the neo-Aristotelian elements of the catechesis mandated by the Council of Trent.

Closely tied to the royal family, La Vallière made her official debut at court in 1661 when she was appointed a lady-in-waiting to Henriette d’Angleterre, the wife of Louis, duc d’Orléans. At the moment of her arrival, court gossips were criticizing the excessive amount of private time Louis XIV was spending with his beautiful sister-in-law. Royal counselors encouraged the king to deflect the rumors of an incestuous affair by appearing to express romantic interest in the new member of Henriette’s entourage, La Vallière. The royal secretary Dangeau ghostwrote a series of romantic letters allegedly written by Louis XIV and La Vallière; other courtiers arranged late-night meetings between the king and the lady-in-waiting that projected the air of a romantic tryst. The ruse quickly became fact as Louis XIV become infatuated with the cultured new courtier. La Vallière was recognized as the official royal mistress and bore the king four children: Charles (1663-65), Philippe (1665-66), Marie Anne de Bourbon (1666-1739), and Louis de Bourbon (1667-83). The king later legitimized his two surviving children and ennobled them under the respective titles Mademoiselle de Blois and Comte de Vermandois.

During her years as royal mistress, La Vallière continued to pursue her artistic and literary interests. She attended performances of Racine and Molière, read the period’s fashionable novels, and took courses in painting at the Académie Royale. La Vallière showed a predilection for philosophical issues. In salon circles, she was known for her well-informed discussions on Aristotle’s Nicomachean Ethics and Descartes’s Discourse on Method. Her circle of close intellectual friends was dominated by thinkers of a libertine tendency, notably Benserade and Lauzun.

In 1667, Louis XIV elevated La Vallière’s social status further by granting her the title of Duchesse de Vaujours, accompanied by the substantial estate at Vaujours. But 1667 also marked the end of La Vallière’s ascendancy with the emergence of a rival, Madame de Montespan, who would ultimately displace La Vallière in the affection of the monarch and become the principal royal mistress.

Long troubled by scruples over her adulterous affair, La Vallière underwent a religious crisis in 1670. After recovering from a serious illness, possibly smallpox, she made a confession of her sins and returned to the regular practice of the Catholic faith. Under the direction of the court preacher Bossuet, La Vallière abandoned the social activities of the court and began to lead a penitential life of prayer and mortification. Renouncing her former libertine allies, La Vallière allied herself to the parti dévot, a group of pious lay courtiers who opposed the moral decadence of the court. In her new spiritual reading, La Vallière discovered the works of the Catholic Counter-Reformation, in particular Saint Teresa of Avila’s Path of Perfection, with its ascetical and mystical conception of virtue and beatitude. Under the influence of Bossuet in 1671, La Vallière wrote a theological work, Reflections on the Mercy of God, which paralleled the divine attribute of mercy with the virtues proper to the repentant sinner.

The sudden conversion of a Versailles courtesan turned La Vallière into a religious celebrity but humiliated Louis XIV, whose sexual infidelities and religious hypocrisy had become public knowledge. Only in 1674 did the monarch permit his former mistress to pursue her vocation as a nun. On April 19, 1674, La Vallière entered the Carmelite convent in Paris, where she would henceforth be known as Soeur Louise de la Miséricorde. Preaching to a convent packed by the capital’s religious elite, Bishop Jean-Louis de Fromentière of Aires denounced the immorality of the court at Versailles; according to the bishop, La Vallière’s entry into the austerity of Carmel amounted to a moral miracle. On June 4, 1675, Soeur Louise pronounced her vows as a Carmelite nun. Queen Marie-Thérèse, the wife of Louis XIV, personally headed the congregation and witnessed the apotheosis of the former courtesan who had defied Versailles. Preaching at the ceremony of profession, Bossuet pointedly drew the lesson that even the world’s most powerful persons must repent of their sins and cease their abuses of power.

During her secluded decades in the convent, Soeur Louise de la Miséricorde lived an exemplary life as a Carmelite nun, noted for the rigor of her penitential practices. She did, however, continue the correspondence she had begun during her conversion with the lay leader of the parti dévot, Maréchal de Bellefonds. Her letters show the clear spiritual influence of the école française by their recurrent stress on abandonment to divine providence and on annihilation of the self. They also contain an ongoing critique of the immorality, violent ambition, and practical atheism she had witnessed in her court years. In the convent parlor, Soeur Louise occasionally received acquaintances from her previous life: Rancé, Bossuet, Queen Marie-Thérèse, even her old rival, Madame de Montespan, who had also fallen from her former status as royal mistress.

Mademoiselle de la Vallière died on June 6, 1710.

2. Works

La Vallière left two principal works to posterity: the treatise Reflections on the Mercy of God and her spiritual correspondence with the Maréchal de Bellefonds. The erratic history of the commentary and publication of these two works indicate how easily the philosophical reflection of women authors has been erased from the canon.

In 1671 in the immediate aftermath of her religious conversion, La Vallière composed Reflections on the Mercy of God. A semi-autobiographical work, this treatise studies the mercy of God for sinners, especially for courtesans who have renounced their sexual sins and sought a new penitential life in exile from the excesses of the court. The author appeals to feminine figures of repentance and sanctity in the New Testament, notably Saint Mary Magdalene, as paradigms of the conversion which La Vallière has undergone. The work studies how faith, hope, charity, and other theological virtues function in the life of those led to authentic moral reformation through the action of grace. Conversely, it dissects the false variants of faith, hope, and charity produced by the court culture of ambition and avarice. The influence of the theology of Bossuet, her spiritual director during the crisis of conversion, is apparent in the text, although the simple, limpid prose style differs markedly from the more rhetorical and periodic style of Bossuet himself.

The first print edition of Reflections on the Mercy of God appeared anonymously in 1680. A popular work of piety, the book had undergone ten editions by the beginning of the eighteenth century. La Vallière was always considered the author of the book, which was clearly written in her style and full of allusions to her life as a courtesan. Many editions published in her lifetime, such as the Frankfurt and Brussels editions in 1683, explicitly named her as the author, with no demurral from Soeur Louise or her associates. In the nineteenth-century, literary critics noted that the later editions of Reflections used a longer and somewhat more elegant version of the text than had the earlier editions. In 1852, Damas-Hinard claimed that the true author of the book was Bossuet, for whom La Vallière had only served as an amanuensis, but other critics dismissed the claim on the grounds of stylistic differences with Bossuet’s others’ works and of the clearly gendered autobiographical experiences the author had incorporated into the work. Although Bossuet had incontestably influenced the theological opinions of La Vallière and a later editor had imposed some stylistic alterations, the text remained substantially La Vallière’s own.

In 1928, the literary critic Marcel Langlois made a more startling claim: that La Vallière had not written the book at all. Langlois based this claim on the argument that the rationalist tone of the work indicated that it was written by a man rather than by a woman. Furthermore, no woman of the period could have possessed the philosophical and theological culture which the author clearly displays. “We observe that the author reads Holy Scripture in Latin and that he makes references to Aristotle and Descartes. A careful look at the text indicates that there is no trace of a feminine style. We know that Mademoiselle de la Vallière was very depressed at this time and that she was a shy person all her life. On the contrary, on every page, we hear the voice of a man, of a director of conscience.” Led by Jean-Baptiste Eriau, other literary critics immediately refuted Langlois’s claim and reattributed the authorship of the work to La Vallière. They pointed out that La Vallière was renowned precisely for her command of Aristotle and Descartes in salon debates and that many cultured laywomen of the period possessed bilingual Latin-French psalters and New Testaments. The recent textual analyses by Petitfils (1990) and Huertas (1998) have reconfirmed the duchess’s authorship of Reflections on the Mercy of God.

La Vallière’s other extant work, her correspondence with the Maréchal de Bellefonds, underwent a similarly tangled publication history. The first edition of her letters (1767) was so full of errors, omissions, and interpellations as to be corrupt. Her alleged memoirs (1829) were a fabrication. Only Pierre Clément’s two-volume edition of her works in 1860 provided the first reliable publication of her letters to Bellefonds. Her correspondence explores the ascetical and mystical sentiments of the soul and continues the critique of the moral corruption to which the courtier is prone.

3. Moral Philosophy

The primary philosophical interest in the works of La Vallière resides in her treatment of virtue in Reflections on the Mercy of God. She rejects the claims of pagan antiquity to have possessed authentic moral virtues, exalts the theological virtues, and criticizes the moral values of the court as a distortion of the theological virtues, altered to suit ambitious self-interest. Grace, rather than human merit, emerges as the cause of authentic virtue. Instead of minimizing the passions as a hindrance to the cultivation of virtue, La Vallière esteems the human emotions, especially the passion of love, as central to the moral personality of the human agent redeemed by grace.

3a. Virtue Theory

In Reflections on the Mercy of God, La Vallière develops her theory of the theological virtues of faith, hope, and charity. The treatise also diagnoses the opponents and the distortions of the theological virtues in the aristocratic society of the period.

Faith emerges as more than an assent to the truths revealed by God and proposed by the teaching authority of the Catholic Church; it entails a militant opposition to the world. This firmness of faith brooks no compromise with worldly allurements. “O my God, give me…a firm faith that makes me believe in Your words and makes me remember, when the world wants me to follow it, that we cannot serve two masters” (RMD no.4). When authentic, this militant faith comports two other virtues: humility and enlightenment. The humility of faith closely ties the believer to the imitation of Jesus crucified, the opposite of conformity to the world’s concept of glory. A properly enlightened faith continually reminds the believer of the radical superiority of eternal God over the fleeting world in terms of glory.

In her analysis of faith, La Vallière diagnoses the enemies of faith in the cultured society of her age. Three positions in particular earn her rebuke: conventionalism, libertinism, and rationalism. Religious conventionalism has reduced to faith a matter of external ritual, shorn of interior moral conversion. “These are persons who, in the midst of shadows that blind them, refuse to be enlightened by the light of these theological truths. We could say that a soul sunk within the world, without prayer, without reflection, and without consulting God on questions of conduct, is similar to a ship with neither captain nor rudder in the midst of a storm” (RMD no. 22). For the conventional, faith is a simple matter of social conformity.

Libertinism proposes a more explicit rejection of the virtue of faith. Its posture is marked by contempt for the very enterprise of religion. “I will flee with horror all those evil people who parade their libertinism, who brag about their vices, and who, as Scripture says, never consider God in their conduct….These militant libertines can only help to foster irreligion, to destroy the purest reputation, to give us an exaggerated sense of self-worth that merits Your abandonment of us, to honor evil and those who commit it” (RMD no. 15). The libertinism censured in this passage is clearly that of the courtier. The destruction of reputation by malicious gossip and the vanity of proximity to power are the vices of the libertine courtier who holds traditional religion and its allied virtue of humility in contempt.

More subtle than libertinism, rationalism erodes faith by subjecting what lies beyond human reason to the judgment of fallible human reason. La Vallière defends the orthodox faith of those who resist the rationalist attacks on the supernatural. “I speak of those who are astonished to learn that there are some people who believe the histories of Alexander and Caesar but who doubt the history of Jesus Christ…who believe the truth of the gospel preached by a dozen poor preachers and of the establishment of His Church founded on an infinite number of miracles…who believe that so many mysteries incomprehensible to the human mind are pure effects of the omnipotence of Jesus Christ and of His infinite love toward His creatures” (RMD no.22). This critique of rationalism defends the supernatural nature of the object of Christian faith by refusing to remove the miraculous and the mysterious from the content of faith. Tellingly, it attacks historical-critical analysis of the Scriptures, which would undercut the historical veracity of the life of Christ. In this particular line of attack, La Vallière is clearly influenced by her spiritual director Bossuet, who in the 1670s combated the historical-critical exegesis of Richard Simon, an Oratorian scholar who challenged the traditional thesis of the Mosaic authorship of the entire Pentateuch, the five opening books of the Bible.

In her treatment of hope, La Vallière similarly distinguishes between the authentic virtue and its counterfeits in the milieu of the court. True hope emerges as trust in the redemptive power of God. “I implore you, Lord, by the merit of this precious blood that flows from Your sacred wounds that You offer to the eternal Father as the price of my redemption, a true confidence in Your mercies” (RMD no.7). Hope can easily deteriorate into presumption when the sinner forgets divine justice and uses divine mercy as an excuse to delay repentance and moral reform. “If You are a God full of compassion for sinners who return to You with all their hearts with hope in Your mercy, You are a terrifying God toward those who trust in You only to multiply their own offenses and who, having tasted the sweetness of your graces, only mock and hold them in contempt” (RMD no. 7).

In court society, theological hope has been eclipsed by the predominance of a purely secular hope for political and economic advancement. The egocentric hopes of ambition have crowded out the authentic hope of eternal life in Christ. “May this solid hope, showing me the nothingness and fragility of everything we call here below position, fortune, wealth, and grandeur, make me no longer esteem them as most people esteem them. They act as if no other happiness and no other life exist after this one” (RMD no.16). The danger of such a careerist hope is that it ignores rather than explicitly opposes the theological hope of immortality. In such a purely terrestrial version of hope, the promise of eternity simply vanishes from concern.

Like other Christian writers, La Vallière accords primacy to the virtue of charity among the theological virtues. Authentic charity is tempered by courage, the willingness to accept the world’s mockery out of fidelity to God. “Create a new heart in me: a humble, firm, constant, and courageous heart, free from the world and its creatures─a truly Christian heart, whereby I will love You when I must sacrifice my life and fortune in witness to Your name and pay homage to the folly of the cross at the heart of a country and of a nation that consider it a scandal” (RMD no.11). La Vallière’s concept of charity is not one of simple affection toward God and neighbor; it is contextualized as the love of God manifested in a society whose pride and self-esteem hold the cross, the central symbol of God’s love, in contempt.

The opposition to authentic charity is not generic hatred or indifference; it is specifically the contempt of others manifest by an ambitious aristocracy. The malicious gossip of the courtier and of the salonnière is a prominent symptom of the contempt by which the neighbor is humiliated in court society. “We only prize these gross sarcastic remarks and personal attacks, unworthy even for a pagan. We consider as of no consequence words which attack the very soul of our neighbors, which mockingly dissect their faults and which make them appear ridiculous….We dismiss as nothing the destruction of their happiness and reputation as long as we do it with an entertaining laugh” (RMD no.17). In this passage, the aristocratic society of wit is unmasked as the determined enemy of authentic charity, which finds its apotheosis in the humble sacrifice of the cross.

3b. Nature and Grace

For La Vallière, nature itself cannot cause moral virtue to exist, since nature exists in a state of postlapsarian corruption. All moral virtue, and not only the theological virtues, requires God’s grace to emerge and mature.

Reflections on the Mercy of God argues that traditional moral virtues, even the cardinal virtues, are only masks for various vices. The alleged virtue of prudence, for example, dissembles the human desire for security. “God did not take flesh and die for us in order to grant our salvation through a comfortable life, according to the prudence of the sense and of the flesh….These moral virtues have no merit whatsoever before You if they are not animated by the merits and virtues of Jesus Christ” (RMD no.6). Freed from the ingrained self-centeredness of human nature, authentic moral virtues constitute variations of the theological virtues, which are in turn the unmerited gift of God’s grace rather than products of human initiative.

This disjunction between apparent natural virtue and authentic supernatural virtue extends to the realm of intellectual virtue. La Vallière sharply opposes the natural wisdom of the world, prized by philosophers, to the wisdom of the cross, revealed only by divine grace. “Give me…less human and natural lights, out of fear that by following them rather than the lights of Your grace, I would lose myself. By following them, instead of being a humble Christian, my self-love would turn me into a socialite philosopher, filled more with false maxims than with the science of the cross….This is the wisdom God hides from the haughty and reveals to the humble. This is the wisdom which overturns prudence and which follows the movements of grace from Jesus Christ” (RMD no.5). Rather than building on the wisdom of the world, the grace-inspired wisdom of the cross reveals the falsehood of the world’s account of what is true and valuable. In the exercises of the intellect as in those of the will, only grace can permit the human agent to embrace actual, rather than counterfeit, goods.

3c. Theory of Passions

Whereas other moral philosophers of the period discounted or dismissed the passions in their account of the moral life, La Vallière places a positive value upon them in her ethical theory. Rather than being suppressed, the human passions should be presented to God for transformation in the itinerary of religious and moral conversion. “Is it right that having found everything possible to satisfy my passions, which only had idols for their object, I find it difficult or impossible when I have to resurrect the passions and love You with all my heart?” (RMD no.12) Just as the intellect and will must be transformed by grace through the acquisition of authentic wisdom and moral virtue, the emotions must be transformed by God into new sentiments of reverence and devotion. It is love above all that must be altered from the self-centered quest for human esteem into the self-sacrificial adoration of God’s very self.

Prayerful meditation constitutes the privileged locus for the human agent to undergo this grace-inspired emotional transformation. Rather than abolishing the human quest for pleasure, contemplation substitutes spiritual pleasure for the physical pleasures once sought by the sinful. “There [in meditation] You make us find a holy and sovereign pleasure to love You above all things and to come often to speak to You, not only as our father and our God, but as the most tender friend we could ever have. We come to lament before You about all of these passions that tyrannize us, about all these worries that upset us, and about all this sadness that exhausts us. In the sweet exchange of prayer, we may show You the bottom of our hearts” (RMD no.19). In this dialogical form of meditation, the meditant may present his or her emotional distresses before God for healing, just as he or she presents sins for forgiveness. The mature fruit of such meditation is an unconditional love for God that slowly integrates once disordered passions into authentic charity for one’s neighbor.

4. Reception and Interpretation

The reception of the writings of Mademoiselle de La Vallière roughly follows three distinct phases: the devotional, the literary, and the philosophical. In the late seventeenth, eighteenth, and early nineteenth centuries, La Vallière’s Reflections on the Mercy of God constituted a staple of French Catholic devotional literature. Many commentators celebrated her as the French Magdalene and compared her to earlier examples of courtesans who had become public penitents, such as Saint Mary of Alexandria. Madame de Genlis’s popular biography of La Vallière (1818) reflects this devotional image of the royal mistress who miraculously became a cloistered nun.

In the late nineteenth and early twentieth centuries, commentators focused more on the literary dimensions of La Vallière. Illustrated by the works of Cornut (1857), Langlois (1932), and Eriau (1961), the protracted quarrel over the authorship of Reflections on the Mercy of God reflects this literary approach. Petitfils (1990) has continued this scholarly concern for textual questions concerning La Vallière.

Recently, in such commentaries as those of Huertas (1998) and of Conley (2002), a greater emphasis has been given to the intellectual formation and philosophical theories of La Vallière. Recent interest in virtue theory of moral philosophy and the development of a more sectarian ethics in recent Christian moral theology has highlighted the interest of La Vallière’s thesis that authentic moral and intellectual virtue is grounded in grace rather than in nature. The recent feminist expansion of the canon of humanities has also underscored the claims of La Vallière to philosophical status, given her study of canonical philosophers such as Aristotle and Descartes, and also given her contributions to moral psychology through her treatise and correspondence.

5. References and Further Reading

All French to English translations above are by the author of this article.

a. Primary Sources

La Vallière, Françoise-Louise de la Baume Le Blanc, duchesse de. Réfléxions sur la Miséricorde de Dieu, suivies de ses lettres et des sermons pour sa vêture et sa profession, par messieurs d’Aires et de Condom, 2 vols., ed. Pierre Clément. Paris: J. Techner, 1860.
- Despite its dated scholarship, Clément’s edition constitutes the most extensive print collection of writings by and concerning La Vallière.

b. Secondary Sources

Conley, John. The Suspicion of Virtue: Women Philosophers in Neoclassical France. Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 2002), 97-123.
- The chapter studies the moral and social philosophy of La Vallière.
Conley, John. “Suppressing Women Philosophers: The Case of the Early Modern Canon,” Early Modern Women: An Interdisciplinary Journal 2006 1: 99-114.
- The article examines the denial of attribution of authorship to La Vallière and other women philosophers of the period.
Cornut, Romain. Les Réflexions de Madame de la Vallière répentante écrite par elle-même et corrigées par Bossuet, 2^nd ed. Paris: Didier, 1857.
- Although Cornut exaggerates the role of Bossuet in the writing of Reflections, the degree and nature of Bossuet’s influence on La Vallière remains a topic of scholarly dispute.
Eriau, Jean-Baptiste. La Madeleine française: Louise de la Vallière dans sa famille, à la cour, au Carmel. Paris: Nouvelles éditions latines, 1961.
- Eriau refutes Langlois’s misattribution of authorship of Reflections and restores the rightful attribution to La Vallière.
Genlis, Stéphanie, comtesse de. La Duchesse de la Vallière. Paris: Maradan, 1818.
- This romanticized biography of La Vallière reflects the image of the repentant courtesan which had captivated the French Catholic public.
Huertas, Monique de. Louise de la Vallière: De Versailles au Carmel. Paris:Pygmalion/Watelet, 1998.
- This biography of La Vallière discusses her participation in the philosophical salons of the period.
Langlois, Marcel. La conversion de Mlle de la Vallière et l’auteur véritable des Réflexions. Paris: Plon, 1932.
- Langlois’s denial of La Vallière’s authorship of Reflections was immediately refuted by other literary critics.
Petitfils, Jean-Christian. Louise de la Vallière. Paris: Perrin, 1990.
- Petifils’s scholarly biography contains a critical edition of an early version of La Vallière’s Reflections on the Mercy of God.

Author Information

John J. Conley
E-mail: jconley1@loyola.edu
Loyola University in Maryland
U. S. A.

Anne-Thérèse Marguenat de Courcelles, marquise de Lambert (1647—1733)

Lambert A prominent salonnière in the France of Louis XIV and the Regency, Madame de Lambert authored numerous essays dealing with philosophical issues. Her most famous works, twin sets of instructions to her son and daughter, analyze the virtues to be cultivated by each gender in the aristocracy. Men pursue glory while women focus on humility. During the literary querelle de la femme, Lambert defends the dignity of women against misogynist stereotypes advanced by opponents of gender equality. In her political writings, she criticizes the vices typical of the hierarchical society of the period, especially the unequal distribution of material goods. The era’s distortion of friendship and mistreatment of the elderly also receive critical scrutiny. Her religious philosophy leans toward the God of deism: a Supreme Being who should be honored for the works of creation but whose attributes do not transcend the categories of human reason. Several works in aesthetics treat the subjective problem of taste and sensibility. Throughout her writings, Lambert manifests her allegiance to a Cartesian understanding of the nature of philosophical analysis. The French Enlightenment recognized the philosophical value of her works, most of which were published posthumously. Fontenelle, Montesquieu, and Voltaire are the most prominent of the Enlightenment thinkers who lauded the philosophical acumen of Lambert.

Biography
Works
Philosophical Themes
Reception and Interpretation
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources
2. Secondary Sources

1. Biography

On September 25, 1647, Anne-Thérèse Marguenat de Courcelles was born in Paris to a provincial aristocratic family from the region of Troyes. Both the paternal and maternal sides of the family had acquired substantial wealth from commercial transactions. An administrator in the Chambre des Comptes, her father Étienne died on May 22, 1650. Her mother Monique Passart then secretly married François Le Coigneux, seigneur de la Roche Turpin et de Bachaumont. Anne-Thérèse received formal instruction at the convent of the Annonciades in Meulan, but it was her stepfather who cultivated the young Ann-Thérèse’s philosophical opinions. A respected poet and memorialist, Bachamount introduced his stepdaughter to the neo-Epicurean philosophy he espoused in his writings. He guided her study of the classics and helped to shape her limpid writing style in French.

On February 22, 1666, Anne-Thérèse married Henri de Lambert, marquis de Saint-Bris en Auxerrois, baron de Chitry et Augy. Henceforth, she will be addressed as Marquise de Lambert or simply Madame de Lambert. Descended from a provincial aristocratic family in Perigord, Henri de Lambert was a military officer who at the time of the marriage served as the captain of the First Company of the Royal Regiment of the Cavalry. The marriage produced four children, one of whom died shortly after birth.

On June 12, 1684, Henri de Lambert reached the pinnacle of his political career when he was named governor of the duchy of Luxembourg. He died suddenly on August 1, 1686. His death was quickly followed by the death of their eleven-year old daughter, Monique. The bereaved Madame de Lambert faced imminent impoverishment since she was locked in a lawsuit with her mother over the estate of her deceased father. Estimated at over five-hundred thousand pounds in worth, the estate had been left entirely to Madame de Lambert’s mother by virtue of a will signed by her father. The bitter adjudication of the will and the conflicting claims of mother and daughter did not end even with the mother’s death in 1692. A royal pension permitted Madame de Lambert to survive and her two remaining children to pursue their education until the juridical controversy was settled largely in Lambert’s favor in the late 1690s.

In 1698 an economically secure Madame de Lambert opened her new residence in the Hôtel de Nevers in Paris. Starting in 1710, she conducted a salon in the drawing room of her residence; it soon became the most intellectually distinguished salon in the capital. She became noted for her contrasting “Tuesday” and “Wednesday” salons. Tuesdays were devoted to men and women of letters. Participants were expected to read aloud their works in progress and to debate the literary issues of the moment. Wednesdays were devoted to more social receptions for the aristocracy living in the capital.

Prominent salon members included the philosophers Fontenelle and Montesquieu, the dramatist Marivaux, the classicist Anne Dacier, the poet Catherine Bernard, the theologian Fénelon, the tale-writer Marie-Catherine d’Aulnoy, and the mathematician Dortous de Mairan. The intellectual distinction of Lambert’s salon earned it the sobriquet of bureau d’esprit (the business office of wit.) The salon also earned a reputation as a place of literary intrigue, especially for lobbying for positions in the prestigious Académie française. Lambert herself was credited with successfully lobbying for the appointment of Montesquieu from her “antechamber to the Académie.” Although Lambert banned political and religious discussions from the salon sessions, her salon enjoyed a mildly libertine reputation. She defended Montesquieu’s controversial Persian Letters, censured for its alleged religious skepticism, and supported Antoine Houdar de la Motte’s attacks on the neoclassical veneration of Homer and of the three unities in drama.

In the salon Madame Lambert shared her own writings with her guests. Her early works were moral exhortations to her son and daughter respectively as they entered adulthood. Later writings dealt with friendship, old age, and aesthetics. Her writings were usually written in the form of a brief essay, modeled after her beloved Montaigne, and often incorporated the miniature literary genres then popular in the salons: maxim, literary portrait, literary dialogue, edifying tale. Madame Lambert’s writings were written uniquely for diffusion in manuscript copies to members of her salon. When a pirated edition of her Counsels of a Mother to her Son appeared in print in 1726, she vehemently protested and bought out what remained of the edition. Publication of a book for public sale in the bookstalls of France was considered inappropriate for an aristocratic woman of the period; furthermore, the intimate details of family life revealed in these essays addressed to her children were not meant to be shared with the general public. Despite Lambert’s protests, pirated print editions of her essays continued to sell briskly and quickly led to unauthorized translations into English.

Although her salon continued to flourish, the last years of Lambert’s life were darkened by the death of her daughter Monique-Thérèse in 1731 and by recurrent bouts of illness. Madame de Lambert died on July 12, 1733.

2. Works

The works of Madame de Lambert attracted a broad European public from the time of the first pirated editions published during her lifetime: Counsels of a Mother to her Son (1726), New Reflections on Women (1727), and Counsels of a Mother to Her Editor (1728). Her collected works enjoyed numerous editions throughout the eighteenth century (1747, 1748, 1750, 1751, 1758, 1761, 1766, 1774, 1785). The English translation of her collected works enjoyed similar popularity in multiple editions (1749, 1756, 1769, 1770, 1781). A German translation of the works appeared in 1750, a Spanish edition in 1781.

Most of Lambert’s extant works are written in the form of a brief essay, with occasional exercises in literary dialogue and literary portraiture. The following works treat philosophical issues. Counsels of a Mother to her Son analyzes the moral virtues an aristocratic man must develop; Counsels of a Mother to her Daughter examines the moral virtues essential for the aristocratic woman. Treatise on Friendship studies the power and difficulty of ethical friendship. Treatise on Old Age laments the neglect of the elderly in contemporary society. Reflections on Wealth decries materialism. Reflections on Taste and Discourse on the Delicacy of Mind and of Sentiment examine aesthetic judgment. Psyche analyzes the nature of the human soul. Dialogue between Alexander and Diogenes criticizes the false glory represented by warriors such as Alexander the Great.

The philosophical influences on Lambert are not difficult to identify. Since her childhood, Lambert carefully noted striking phrases from her reading. In many of her writings, she uses quotations to justify her argument. Two groups of thinkers predominate. The first are classical authors with a marked Stoic orientation: Plutarch, Seneca, Marcus Aurelius, and Cicero. The second are contemporary French authors often considered moralistes, because of their exploration of moral psychology, especially the deceptions of the human mind. Prominent in this second group are Montaigne, La Rochefoucauld, La Bruyère, Pascal, Fénelon and Saint-Evremond. So frequent is Lambert’s use of quotation that some critics have dismissed her writings as a tissue of paraphrases. But Lambert transforms her sources to accommodate her own concerns, notably her concern about the status of women. Lambert cites Cicero’s dissertation on old age but her own essay contains considerations on the impoverishment of aging women that are absent in Cicero. Similarly, the marquise admits the debt of her Counsels of a Mother to her Daughter to Fénelon’s Education of Girls but nowhere does Fénelon develop the argument for the philosophical education of women which Lambert pursues in her own text.

3. Philosophical Themes

Madame Lambert’s writings focus on philosophical themes that preoccupied the more intellectual Parisian salons of the period. In her discussion of the virtues, she makes careful distinctions on the various types of moral virtue, with particular interest in the aristocratic virtue of glory. Like other salonnières, she analyzes the gradations of love and constructs an apology for chaste, intellectual love between adults of the opposite sex. Lambert’s interest in pedagogy springs from the conviction that formation in virtue constitutes the chief purpose of education. Despite her loyalty to the French throne, she criticizes the social injustices of French society, especially its unequal distribution of material wealth, and condemns what she considers the major vices of her own social class. Her philosophical reflections on art focus primarily on the subjective issue of aesthetic appreciation, notably taste and delicacy. A practicing Catholic, she develops a religious philosophy more attuned to the emerging deism of the period. God is the Supreme Being affirmed by rational reflection on the cosmos rather than the personal redeemer known through revelation and grace. Relatively secondary, the virtues of religion are assimilated to the more generic moral virtues of moderation, prudence, and integrity. Lambert’s works develop a gendered philosophy not only because they defend the dignity of women against the misogyny of the period, but because they treat such issues as friendship, education, and old age through the lens of gender differentiation.

a. Virtue Theory

Lambert’s intertwined theories of virtue and education emerge in her two most popular works, Counsels of a Mother to her Son and Counsels of a Mother to her Daughter. In both works, Lambert exhorts her children to grow in virtue as they leave adolescence and begin the commitments of adulthood. She praises the moral habits they have already acquired through their earlier formal education and advises them on the moral dispositions they must obtain in the future. But the virtues central for men are not the same as those vital for women. Like other men, especially those of the nobility destined for military service, her son must pursue glory and its associated public virtues. Like other women, destined primarily for household duties, her daughter should cultivate the more hidden virtues clustered around humility.

For men, the acquisition of the virtue of glory constitutes their highest aspiration. According to Lambert, society has rightly named military valor as the chief title to this virtue. “The glory of heroes is the most brilliant. True marks of honor and acclaim are attached to it. Renown seems personally designed for these men.” In pursuing such glory, men must refuse to limit their ambition through a constraining personal modesty. In fact, such ambition is necessary for gentlemen pursuing glory as long as they refrain from unfair attacks on their enemies or rivals. Lambert conceives the virtue of glory as central to political as well as personal masculine development. Political order is founded on a social contract using the aspiration to glory as a guarantor of civic cohesion. “Men found that it was necessary and useful for them to unite together for the sake of the common good. They made laws to punish the evil. They agreed among themselves what constituted the basic duties of society and attached the idea of glory to the proper practice of these duties.”

The pursuit of grandeur in the military and broader civic forum requires men to develop other social virtues. Like other salonnières of the period, Lambert emphasizes the virtue of honesty (honnêteté), a personal integrity that permits the gentleman to witness the needs of others and to serve them without excessive preoccupation. “If you want to be a perfectly honest man, consider disciplining your self-love and give it a good object. Honesty consists in emptying oneself of focusing on one’s own rights and in respecting the rights of others.” Unlike true glory, with its attendant concern for others, false glory encourages self-gratification and ignores the misery of the other. “Why is it that in this infinite number of desires fabricated by voluptuousness and indulgence one never finds the desire to provide relief for the unfortunate? Doesn’t simple humanity make one feel the need to aid one’s fellow humans? Moral hearts feel more greatly the obligation to do good than they do the other necessities of life.” For Lambert, the cultivation of this altruistic honesty naturally entails the pursuit of other similarly discreet social virtues: politeness, tact, delicacy, and wisdom. Such honesty preserves the gentleman from the typical moral vices of the courtier: envy and avarice.

Unlike men, women are not called to cultivate the social virtues proper to the political sphere; they should develop virtues more appropriate to the domestic sphere of the household. “Women are not called to partake in visible and brilliant virtues; rather, they pursue simple and quiet virtues.” Glory, the central virtue of men, has no role in the retired life of women. “The virtues of women are difficult because glory does not help to practice them. These virtues are hidden: living with oneself; limiting one’s government to one’s family; being simple, just, and modest.” Among other virtues of self-effacement, women are called to pursue humility and temperance. Like the opposite sex, women must cultivate the virtues of honesty and politeness, but their participation in the civic sphere remains more circumscribed than that assigned by Lambert to men.

Despite this limitation of female moral culture to the province of the household, Lambert argues that women must develop a substantial set of intellectual virtues. She insists that women should maintain an intellectual curiosity that leads to a lifetime of learning. “Curiosity is knowledge that has already begun; it will make one go faster and further in the path of truth. It is a natural inclination which goes beyond formal instruction. It must not be stopped by sloth or soft living.” The educational program commended by Lambert for her daughter indicates the substantial intellectual culture Lambert considers desirable for aristocratic women. The program includes the study of Greek, Roman, and French history; the study of ethics through the writings of Cicero and Pliny; the study of literature, especially the tragedies of Corneille; and the study of Latin. Lambert adds a Cartesian note to this ambitious neoclassical curriculum by her approval of the study of philosophy. “[I commend] especially the new sort [of philosophy], if one is capable of it; it will cultivate precision in one’s mind, clarify one’s thoughts, and teach one to think correctly.” This apology for serious intellectual, specifically philosophical, formation for women is allied to the critique of the neglect of women’s education with which she opens Counsels of a Mother to her Daughter. “Throughout time we have neglected the education of women; we only paid attention to that of men. We acted as if women were a different kind of species. We abandoned them to themselves without any assistance and without the slightest consideration that they constitute half of the world.”

Despite this gendered differentiation in the treatment of the moral virtues, men and women are summoned to develop one virtue in common: the capacity to live by oneself and to rely on one’s own rational judgment. This neo-Stoic ability to find interior rational peace is the key to mature happiness for both sexes. Counsels of a Mother to her Son describes this virtue as “the happiness of knowing how to live with oneself, to find oneself with pleasure, to leave oneself with regret.” In Counsels of a Mother to her Daughter, Lambert exhorts her daughter to “learn that the greatest science is to know how to be alone with yourself….Provide yourself with an interior place of retreat or asylum. There you can always return to yourself and find yourself.” In this contemplative self-possession, wherein the passions are subordinated to reason, both men and women discover the interior resources to combat the vicissitudes of existence, especially of reversal of fortune.

b. Gender and Dignity

In New Reflections On Women, Lambert provides an apology for the dignity and rights of women. The essay criticizes the misogyny which has denied women a proper education. “Can’t women say to men, ‘What right do you have to forbid us to study the sciences and fine arts? Haven’t women who have devoted themselves to these disciplines produced both sublime and useful objects?’” As contemporary examples of such success, the essay cites Madame de la Sablière, an astronomer, and the many recent women novelists. Lambert laments the decline of the salons which had earlier contributed to the artistic and philosophical formation of women. “In other times there were houses where it was permitted to speak and to think, where the Muses held company with the Graces….These houses were like the Banquet of Plato.” The social constitution which reduces women to inferiors and denies them the possibility of scientific culture does not reflect nature or rights; it is simply a corporate act of violence by men to retain their supremacy and to maintain the domestic services of women without appropriate compensation. “By force rather than by natural right, men have usurped authority over women.” The period’s art, notably Molière’s parody of the précieuses in Women Scholars, conspires to persuade women that their legal subjection and exclusion from serious education is a product of nature rather than of culpable oppression.

Despite her critique of the period’s subjection of women, Lambert accepts the common argument that the difference between the genders is psychological and not only biological. In particular, she accepts the argument advanced by Malebranche that women have a more active faculty of imagination than do men. But whereas Malebranche and others had drawn the conclusion that this hyperactive imagination prevents women from exercising reason (and concomitantly from governing others), Lambert draws the opposite conclusion. The essay claims that women’s natural vivacity of imagination and sentiment actually perfects the operations of reason. Rather than being the antagonist of reason, imagination incites reason to undertake great projects and makes the fruits of reasoning more persuasive to the public. “I do not think that sentiment weakens the mind; on the contrary, it provides new spiritual powers which illuminate the mind. It makes the ideas present in the mind livelier, clearer, and more distinct….Persuasion of the heart is higher than that of the mind alone because our conduct often depends on the former. It is to our imagination and to our heart that nature has committed the conduct of our actions and of its motives.” Rather than being inferior to men, women appear to possess a certain mental superiority. The success of ancient and contemporary women in the arts and sciences indicates that they are as capable as are men in pursuing intellectual activities. Only social prejudice, expressed through the denial of appropriate education, explains the comparative paucity of women who have distinguished themselves in these fields. The alleged greater attachment of women to the exercise of the imagination and of the sentiments in their decision-making only indicates that in an atmosphere free of gender prejudice women will exercise reason with a greater complement of imagery and of passion than do most men.

c. Ethics of Love

In several works, Lambert focuses on the central issue of salon debate: the nature of love. She insists on the moral qualities necessary for authentic love and decries the descent into sexual debauchery that has characterized several prominent salons of the Regency. The chaste love of mature friendship is both more desirable and more difficult to attain than is the passion-based love of romance. Intellectual love between adults of the opposite sex constitutes the apex of this ideal moral friendship.

New Reflections on Women defines love as the central sentiment of human life. Due to its interiority and its power, love enjoys a primacy among human sentiments. “The difference between love and other pleasures is easy to detect for those who have been touched by it. In order to be felt, most pleasures require the presence of the proper external object. Music, cuisine, and theater are examples of pleasures that must have their immediate object in order to make their impressions, to call the soul to them and to hold the soul attentive….It is not the same with love. It is within us, it is a part of ourselves. It does not only exist in tandem with its corresponding object; we can experience love without the presence of the object.” The superiority of love over other desires springs from the capacity of its sentiments to dominate the moral agent even in the absence of the beloved other person. Memory and imagination deepen the force of a sentimental state that can captivate the human subject on the basis of fantasy alone.

Despite Lambert’s correlation of love with pleasure, Treatise on Friendship underscores that the highest form of love is disinterested friendship among peers rather than romantic affection. Such mature friendship is based on virtue rather than passion. “The first merit we must seek in our friends is virtue. This is what assures us that they are capable and worthy of friendship. We should expect nothing from our relationships which lack this foundation.” Focused on the needs of the other, authentic friendship frees one from self-preoccupation and encourages altruistic service of the beloved. “Friendship is a relationship, a contract, or a type of reciprocal commitment where one demands nothing, where the most worthy person gives more than is expected and is happy to do so in advance. One shares one’s fortune with one’s friend: wealth, credit, concern, services, everything except one’s honor.” Only in this virtuous friendship is the human person freed from the calculation of conquest and approval which characterizes most interpersonal affection.

Departing from its classical precedents, Treatise on Friendship argues that such a virtuous, altruistic friendship is not limited to peers of the same sex. Chaste, intellectual friendship between members of the opposite sex constitutes the highest embodiment of such a meritorious relationship since it demands strict discipline of one’s personal passions. “They ask if friendship can endure among members of different sex. Although it is rare and difficult, this is the most delightful of friendships. It is the most difficult because it requires more virtue and more restraint.” At its apogee in altruistic friendship, the sentiment of love is so thoroughly refined by the rational will that the passions can no longer distort it.

d. Social Criticism

Like other moralistes of the period, Lambert criticizes the injustices of French society. Economic inequality constitutes one of the principal injustices of this highly stratified society. Avarice constitutes the major vice of an aristocracy transformed into avid courtiers.

Reflections on Wealth describes the rapacious efforts to acquire material wealth as a distortion of the human quest for happiness. Whereas human beings can only find authentic happiness in the intellectual and moral goods of the soul, the social elite seeks an illusory happiness in the amassment of ever-increasing fortunes. Such wealth may procure social approval and temporary pleasure, but the illusory nature of this unstable pleasure inevitably manifests itself. “Riches are vain in their use and insatiable in their possession of us. They are vain because of the false idea they give of themselves. This idea is founded not on our real being but on our imaginary being. Everything surrounding those favored with wealth serves their illusions.” This illusion magnifies the egocentrism of a humanity marked by the fall. Other people, even the earth itself (with its deposits of precious metals), become objects which exist to be exploited by and to adorn an aristocracy poisoned by avarice.

Despite its moral tares, this human avidity possesses a certain public utility. The desire to be admired for one’s wealth-related grandeur drives many of the wealthy to provide a material assistance toward the poor which they would not otherwise give. “Nothing is so great and nothing gives us such an illustrious position in the imagination of others as does the contribution of our wealth to the public weal. Making one’s wealth flow to so many unfortunates is to give them a new type of existence which pulls them out of their desperate state.” Like many social thinkers of the eighteenth-century, Lambert identifies material self-interest as the motor of public philanthropy.

Lambert’s critique of the intolerable lot of the poor in contemporary French society becomes explicitly gendered in her Treatise of Old Age. It is women who bear the brunt of the material impoverishment and psychological isolation of old age. “Throughout their lives, we have given men all the assistance necessary to perfect their reason and to teach them the great science of happiness. Cicero composed a treatise on old age to help them draw benefits from an age where everything seems to leave us. We do this work only for men. For women in all ages, on the contrary, we simply abandon them to themselves. We neglect their education in their youth. During the rest of their lives, we deprive them of the support they need for their old age. As a result, the majority of women live without care and without the ability to reflect on their state. In their youth they are vain and dissipated; in their old age, frail and disheveled.” It is the deprivation of education, especially of the methodical formation of reason and of the capacity for personal reflection, which provokes the material and psychological impoverishment of women, once their romantic and maternal utility has vanished. The result of neither nature nor accident, this impoverishment of aging women reflects the gender imbalance of a society centered around the needs of men.

e. Religious Philosophy

Lambert’s writings exhibit the nascent deism of the period. Although she repeatedly praises the virtue of piety, Lambert accords religious virtues a palpably secondary role in the constellation of moral virtues she commends to her readers. Religion provides a cornerstone for the moral virtues the human person must cultivate, but the deity presiding over this religious theology is the deist Supreme Being rather than the biblical God of redemption and grace.

The deistic character of Lambert’s religious philosophy appears clearly in her Counsels of a Mother to her Son. Although she insists that the greatest duty of the son is to “render worship to the Supreme Being,” this religious sentiment is markedly constricted. The purpose of religion is to inspire the moral agent to fulfill his or her duties. Prayer is an occasion to compare oneself with the moral order God has manifested in the cosmos. “Moral virtues are in danger without the Christian ones. I do not ask from you a piety full of weaknesses and superstition; I only ask that a love of moral order would submit to God your inclinations and your sentiments and that the same love of order would spill over on your conduct. That will give you justice and the presence of justice will guarantee the existence of all the virtues.” Religion is instrumentalized as an efficacious tool of moral formation and motivation. Communion with God is based not on grace but on rational scrutiny of one’s conformity to the moral order detectable in nature. It is the natural virtue of justice, and not the supernatural virtues of faith, hope, and charity, which constitutes the apex of the moral virtues fostered by an enlightened religiosity shorn of irrationality and superstition.

The religious virtue praised by Lambert is generic in nature. Respect for religion entails respect for the particular religion established by the sovereign of the state. “One does not attack religion when one has no interest in attacking it. Nothing makes one happier than having the mind convinced and the heart touched by religion. That is a good in all times. Even those who are not fortunate enough to believe as they choose should submit to the established religion. They know that what is called ‘prejudice’ has great standing in society and that it must be respected.” The treatment of religious truth in this passage is markedly skeptical. The assimilation of religion to a popular ‘prejudice’ is not refuted; it is simply useful to respect such a widespread belief, even if it is tainted by custom and bias. The particular religion to be respected and embraced varies from one society to another, since it is the religious confession established by the state. In France, this is Catholicism defended by the monarchy, but in other cultures this can easily be another religious confession whose tenets are enforced by a different type of political sovereignty.

Other writings, notably Counsels of a Mother to Daughter and Treatise on Old Age, commend the virtue of piety to women. But despite the occasional Christian references, the religious sentiment lauded by Lambert remains closer to rationalist deism than to the Catholic sentiment of adoration and submission rooted in grace.

f. Aesthetics

In several works, Lambert studies the subjective dimension of aesthetics. She explores how the taste for beauty develops in the human mind. She also studies the related mental qualities of delicacy and refinement, which permit the human person to recognize beauty in nature or in artifacts.

Reflections on Taste concedes an irreducible subjectivity to the phenomenon of taste. Whereas discursive reasoning inevitably leads to certain conclusions according to the rules of logic and of evidence, judgments of taste often evince irresolvable contradictions. “Taste is the first movement and a type of instinct which draws us and guides us more surely than all the work of reason. There is no necessary agreement among tastes. This is not the same thing as among truths. It is obvious that whoever concedes my premises will also agree with the consequences I draw. In this way one may lead an intelligent person to accept one’s opinion, but one is never sure that one can lead a sensitive person to one’s judgment of taste. There are no links or enticements to make someone else agree with this judgment. Nothing is certain in the domain of taste; everything springs from the disposition of one’s interior organs and the relationship established between them and external objects.” Despite its power over the human person’s judgment, taste delivers subjective judgments inasmuch as it depends on the physiology and the psychology unique to each person in the exercise of aesthetic perception.

Despite this subjective dimension, the essay insists that some judgments of taste are more justified than are others. Although taste eludes analytic definition, it can be evoked intuitively for those who have experienced the difference in quality of aesthetic judgments. “Right taste delivers a proper judgment on everything we call pleasing, satisfying, fitting, fine, or, so to speak, the flora of the soul. It is this je ne sais quoi of wisdom and of skillfulness, which knows what is appropriate and which senses in each object the correct proportion it must possess.” Although judgments of taste do not follow the strict logic of discursive reason, they are not arbitrary. Irreducible to a formula, experience indicates that certain minds excel in the recognition of the obscure formal qualities that constitute the beauty of an external object.

Against emotivism and relativism, Lambert argues that the faculty of taste possesses a partial intellectual dimension. “Up to the present, good taste has been defined as ‘a custom established for the members of high society who are sophisticated and discriminating.’ I think that good taste depends on two things: a sentiment of great delicacy in the heart and a great correctness in the mind.” If Lambertian taste begins as a subjective movement of instinct and feeling, it only reaches its mature term when the intellect has refined this initial impression through a scrutiny of the formal qualities, especially the harmony and balance, of the external object under consideration.

g. Cartesianism

Lambert’s writings make few explicit references to Descartes, but her writings are suffused with Cartesian philosophy. Although the degree of her personal knowledge of the texts of Descartes remains unclear, Lambert clearly imbibed the pervasive Cartesianism of the salons, militantly diffused in her own salon by Fontenelle.

The literary portrait Monsieur de la Motte provides a Cartesian definition of philosophy. “To philosophize is to render to reason all its dignity and to make it enter into its rights. It is to relate each object to its proper principles. It is to shake off the yoke of opinion and of authority.” In its attack on public opinion and appeals to authority as the antonym of right reason, this rationalist concept of philosophy clearly follows the path of Cartesianism.

In several works, this Cartesian apology for reason warns the reader of the dangers of reliance on public opinion. Counsels of a Mother to her Daughter emphasizes the necessity to abandon prejudice, custom, and public opinion if one seeks to reason properly. “Give yourself a true idea of things. Don’t judge like the common people do. Don’t yield your judgment to that of public opinion. Throw off the prejudices of childhood.” Similarly, the Dialogue between Alexander and Diogenes on the Equality of Goods condemns Alexander the Great’s reliance on the esteem of the public. “I know very well that you [Alexander] have the masses for you. The number of the wise is very small. As much as you are a prince, you are still a man of the common people in your way of thinking. Always dependant on the opinion of other people, you place your happiness in the judgments of others.” It is Diogenes, the representative of the intellectual elite which relies on reason rather than on fluctuating public opinion, who has access to the truth.

Lambert’s Cartesian orientation often emerges in her treatment of specific areas of human endeavor. Counsels of a Mother to Her Son considers history, focused on human passions and chance events, as inferior to the study of metaphysics, where the student can discover universal, immutable principles. “Your ordinary reading must be history, but you must join reflection to it. Don’t think of filling your memory with facts, of decorating your mind with the thoughts and opinions of authors. This would only turn your mind into a store filled with the ideas of other people. A quarter of an hour of reflection does more to deepen and form the mind than do hours of reading. You should not fear a lack of knowledge; rather, you should fear error and false judgments. Reflection is the guide leading to truth.” Counsels of a Mother to her Daughter closely follows Descartes’s Discourse on Method in its exemption of religion from the rationalist censure of appeals to authority. “In the area of religion, one must yield to authorities, but on every other subject, one must only accept the authority of reason and of evidence.” As a result of this split in warrants between religious and non-religious knowledge, theological belief becomes a matter of arational assent. “As a great man [Malebranche] said, ‘To be a Christian, one must believe blindly; to be wise, one must see the evidence.” In this Cartesian framework, reason is not only to be exercised in metaphysics and science to discover indubitable, immutable principles; it is be used in other areas of human life to eliminate or at least to temper the weight of authority and custom on human judgment.

4. Reception and Interpretation

The reception of Madame de Lambert’s writings and philosophy has been checkered. In the eighteenth century a large, cultivated European public purchased numerous editions of her works in French, English, German, and Spanish. French Enlightenment philosophers, notably Bayle, Fontenelle, Montesquieu, and Voltaire, praised her contribution to moral philosophy. By the late nineteenth century, however, Lambert was little read. It is significant that the first twentieth-century edition of Lambert’s works occurred only at the very end of the century (1990) with Granderoute’s critical edition.

Several factors explain the eclipse of Lambert’s philosophy. First, the marquise wrote in the style of literary miniatures that were popular in the salons of the period. She often expressed her philosophy in the genre of the essay, the literary dialogue, the maxim, or the literary portrait. Genres that appeared charming in the boudoirs of the Regency often appeared precious to a later literary public. Written outside the framework of the systematic treatise, the essays’ arguments on virtue or politics or aesthetics often seemed unphilosophical to a later philosophical public accustomed to university norms of academic argument.

Second, Madame de Lambert wrote from and for a philosophical culture which has vanished. She could presume that her listeners had studied the Stoicism of Plutarch and Cicero in their schooldays as she had. Even indirect references to the classical authors would be immediately grasped. Paraphrases of Montaigne or Pascal required no further explanation. Any educated Frenchman or Frenchwoman in the early eighteenth century would possess at least a hazy outline of the skepticism represented by each of these masters of modern French prose.

The recent renaissance of philosophical interest in Lambert is tied to the neo-feminist expansion of the cannon of the humanities in early modernity. Several recent studies focus on the question of gender and the status of women in Lambert. The interpretations offered by Fassiotto (1984) and Beasely (1992) illustrate this tendency. Other contributions by Lambert to moral philosophy, such as her virtue theory and her critique of the influence of popular opinion on moral judgment, await further research.

5. References and Further Reading

All translations from French to English above are by the author of this article.

a. Primary Sources

Lambert, Anne-Thérèse de Marguenat de Courcelles, marquise de. Oeuvres complètes de madame la marquise de Lambert. Paris: L. Collin, 1808.
- A digital version of this edition of the works of Madame de Lambert is available at Gallica: bibliothèque numérique on the website of the Bibliothèque nationale de France.
Lambert, Anne-Thérèse de Marguenat de Courcelles, marquise de. Oeuvres, ed. Robert Granderoute. Paris: Librairie Honoré Champion, 1990.
- This excellent critical edition of the works of Madame de Lambert has become the standard scholarly edition.
Lambert, Ann-Thérèse de Marguenat de Courcelles, marquise de. The Works of the Marchionesse de Lambert. Containing Thoughts on various entertaining and useful Subjects, Reflections on Education, on the writings of Homer and on various public Events of the Time. Carefully Translated from the French. London: William Owen, 1749.
- This first English translation of the collected works of Madame de Lambert underwent four re-editions in the eighteenth century. Digital texts of the English versions of several of Lambert’s works can be found at the following Internet sites: American Libraries Internet Archive and Google Book Search.

b. Secondary Sources

Barth-Cao Danh, Michèle. La philosophie cognitive et morale d’Anne-Thérèse de Lambert, 1647-1733: La volonté d’être. New York: Peter Lang, 2002.
- This original monograph studies the epistemology of Madame de Lambert.
Beasely, Faith. “Anne-Thérèse de Lambert and the Politics of Taste,” Papers on French Seventeenth Century Literature, 1992, Vol. 19; no.37: 337-44.
- The article focuses on gender in its analysis of aesthetic judgment and politics in Lambert.
Daniélou, Catherine. “L’amour-propre éclairé: Madame de Lambert et Pierre Nicole,” Papers on French Seventeenth Century Literature, 1995, Vol. 22, no. 42: 171-83.
- [Daniélou contrasts the link between self-love and social utility in the philosophies of Lambert and of the Jansenist Nicole
Fassiotto, Marie-José. Madame de Lambert (1644-1733), ou, Le féminism moral. New York: Peter Lang, 1984.
- Fassiotto explores gender issues in Lambert but the attribution of feminism is anachronistic.
Granderoute, Robert. “Madame de Lambert et Montaigne,” Bulletin de la Société des Amis de Montaigne, 1981, nos. 7-8: 97-106.
- Granderoute demonstrates the dependence of Lambert on the thought and texts of Montaigne.
Granderoute, Robert. “De l’Education des filles aux Avis d’une mère à une fille: Fénelon et madame de Lambert,” Revue d’Histoire littéraire de la France,” 1987, no. 1: 15-30.
- Granderoute examines the influence of Fénelon on Lambert’s educational philosophy.
Hine, Ellen McNiven. Madame de Lambert, her Sources and her Circle. Oxford: The Voltaire Foundation, 1973.
- Hine studies Lambert’s ancient and contemporary intellectual sources.
Hoffman, Paul. “Madame de Lambert et l’exigence de dignité,” Travaux de linguistique et de littérature, 1973, vol. 11, no. 2: 19-32.
- Hoffman analyzes the central concept of dignity in the ethics and political thought of Lambert.
Kryssing-Berg, Ginette, “La marquise de Lambert ou l’ambivalence de la vertu,” Revue Romane, 1982, Vol. 17: 35-45.
- Kryssing-Berg studies the tension between virtue and social utility in Lambert’s ethics.
Marchal, Roger. Madame de Lambert et son milieu. Oxford: The Voltaire Foundation, 1991.
- Marchal examines the aristocratic and salon context of Lambert’s thought.

Author Information

John J. Conley
E-mail: jconley1@loyola.edu
Loyola University in Maryland
U. S. A.

Françoise d’Aubigné, marquise de Maintenon (1635—1719)

The second wife of King Louis XIV of France, Madame de Maintenon has long fascinated historians and novelists by her improbable life. Born into an impoverished, criminal family, Maintenon conquered salon society as the wife of the poet Paul Scarron. During her salon years, she studied the philosophical currents of the period, notably libertinism and Cartesianism. Maintenon then conquered court society as the governess of the illegitimate children of King Louis XIV and finally as the wife of the widowed King. The controversies surrounding her social ascent have long obscured the contributions of Maintenon to educational and moral philosophy. The founder and director of the celebrated school for women at Saint-Cyr, Maintenon defended her theories of education for women in a series of addresses to the Saint-Cyr faculty. In her pedagogical philosophy, practical moral formation rather than intellectual cultivation emerges as the primary goal of schooling. Her dramatic dialogues and addresses to students developed her distinctive moral philosophy, based on detailed analysis of the moral virtues to be cultivated by the pupils. In her account of the cardinal virtues, temperance holds pride of place. Addressing Saint-Cyr’s student body of aristocratic girls and women, Maintenon devoted particular attention to the virtues of civility essential for polite society. Her philosophy of virtues is a gendered one inasmuch as Maintenon attempted to redefine traditionally masculine virtues in terms of current female experience.

Biography
Works
Philosophical Themes
Reception and Interpretation
References and Further Reading

1. Biography

Françoise d’Augbigné was born on November 27-28, 1635, allegedly in the prison of Niort in central France. Her father Constant d’Aubigné was a career criminal who had received jail terms for murder, kidnapping, treason, and debt. Disowned by his father Agrippa d’Aubigné, a prominent Huguenot military officer and poet, Constant d’Aubigné had married Jeanne de Cardhilac, daughter of Niort’s prison warden, in 1627. Françoise’s harrowing childhood included a stay in Martinique (1645-1647) during one of her father’s failed political adventures; a bitter stay with a distant relative who used her as a domestic servant (1648); tempestuous periods at Ursuline convent schools in Niort and Paris (1648); and a painful return to her impoverished mother (1649-1652), during which time the young Françoise was forced to beg in the streets. A personal witness to the religious divisions of the period, she was baptized Catholic by her mother at birth, raised as a Protestant by her kindly aunt, Madame de Villette, and then converted to Catholicism by her Ursuline teachers. The adolescent study of Plutarch introduced her to the period’s vogue for Stoicism and cultivated her lifelong taste for the literature of moral edification.

In 1652 Françoise d’Aubigné married her only suitor: the poet Paul Scarron. The odd match became an object of ridicule in the Parisian salons. Twenty-five years her senior, Scarron was a paralyzed, impotent satirist renowned for the vitriol of his verse burlesques. Despite its unpromising origins, the marriage proved a reasonable success. Madame Scarron patiently nursed a sickly husband who visibly esteemed his beautiful and intelligent young wife. The tiny apartment of the Scarrons quickly became a salon for Parisian authors of a libertine bent. Madame Scarron acquired a philosophical culture from the salon habitués: Benserade, Chapelain, Vivonne, Saint-Aignan, Costar, and Ménage. She was especially influenced by George Brossin, chevalier de Méré, the essayist who argued that the honnête homme, the temperate person who exercised restraint in arriving at judgments, should be the moral ideal of an age exhausted by religious fanaticism. During these salon sessions Madame Scarron also read and debated the works of Descartes.

At the death of her husband in 1660, Madame Scarron faced a precarious future, but her salon contacts permitted her to find some financial support and to continue her pursuit of literary and philosophical culture. In 1669 she accepted a delicate mission: to serve as the governess for the illegitimate children of Louis XIV and her fellow salonnière, Madame de Montespan. Her skillful education of the children impressed the king and his stormy mistress. Her expert nursing of their son, the Duke of Maine, during a serious illness appeared to them miraculous. In 1674, a grateful Louis XIV granted the devoted governess the lands and title of the fief of Maintenon. Newly ennobled and financially secure, Madame de Maintenon now took her own place as a titled aristocrat among the courtiers of Versailles. When the affair between Louis XIV and Madame de Montespan collapsed, Maintenon encouraged the king to reconcile with his estranged wife, Marie-Thérèse of Austria. The successful reconciliation between the spouses enhanced Maintenon’s standing in court but earned her the enmity of her old patron, Madame de Montespan.

After the sudden death of Queen Marie-Thérèse on July 9, 1683, the king drew closer to Maintenon. On October 9, 1683, the archbishop of Paris married the couple in a private ceremony. The bride’s modest social origins raised a problem, since Louis XIV had insisted on dynastic marriages for other members of his family. The marriage was never publicly announced, although the court quickly perceived that Madame de Maintenon had assumed the role and duties of Louis XIV’s legitimate wife. The private marriage was also morganatic; Maintenon would never assume the title of queen and no relative of hers could claim the right to the throne.

In 1684 Maintenon began her life’s work: the construction of a school for the education of daughters of the impoverished nobility. Situated in 1686 at Saint-Cyr, the Institute of Saint Louis was generously subsidized by Louis XIV. Maintenon personally supervised the direction of the school, designed to serve two hundred and fifty students. The school possessed a comparatively sophisticated curriculum, featuring courses in religion, reading, writing, mathematics, Latin, music, painting, dancing, needlework, and home economics. Dissatisfied with the narrowly religious education provided by the convent schools of the period, Maintenon founded her own lay group of teachers, the Dames of Saint-Louis, to provide instruction. Maintenon insisted that dialogue rather than lecture was to be the primary means of education in the Saint-Cyr classroom.

Saint-Cyr underwent three distinct periods in its pedagogical development. In its artistic period (1686-1689), the school emphasized cultural achievement by its students. Sophisticated concerts, plays, debates, and liturgical services soon attracted a prestigious Parisian public. The artistic period achieved its culmination in the world premiere of Jean Racine’s Esther on January 26, 1689. The cultural triumph of the school, however, created educational problems. Dazzled by the applause of the court, students began to neglect their studies; class time began to shrink in favor of rehearsals for the elaborate school performances.

During its mystical period (1690-97), Maintenon sought to combat the worldliness of the earlier artistic phase by promoting piety in the school. The faculty and students soon fell under the influence of Madame de Guyon, a controversial religious leader and friend of Maintenon. The Quietism promoted by Guyon stressed simplicity in prayer, confidence in God, and retirement from the world. Maintenon grew disenchanted with a piety that seemed to undercut the acquisition of virtue and ardor in one’s studies and future work. By the middle of the decade, Maintenon encouraged Louis XIV’s campaign against Quietism and the expulsion of faculty sympathetic to Quietism.

By the end of the seventeenth century, Maintenon had guided Saint-Cyr toward the pedagogical model she would support until her death. This approach to education stressed the acquisition of moral virtues by the students and development of the practical skills these impoverished women would need in their future lives as wives of provincial aristocrats in straitened financial circumstances. This practical mode of education, with its distinctive moralistic coloration, would remain the guiding ethos of Saint-Cyr until its dissolution by revolutionaries in 1793.

Given the secret nature of her marriage, Maintenon’s influence on the court of Louis XIV remained a discreet one. She clearly counseled her husband on religious matters, especially the appointment of bishops and abbots, but her role in the Revocation of the Edict of Nantes and the intensification of anti-Protestant measures by Louis XIV has been exaggerated by later critics. Her primary interest remained the direction of the school at Saint-Cyr, to which she retired in 1715, shortly after the death of Louis XIV.

Madame de Maintenon died at Saint-Cyr on April 17, 1719.

2. Works

The majority of the works left by Madame de Maintenon originated during her tenure at the Institute of Saint Louis (1686-1719). The Dames of Saint-Louis carefully transcribed the many addresses Maintenon delivered to the faculty and student body. Maintenon would then correct and revise the transcriptions. In addition, she composed dramatic monologues to be performed in class. The Dames collected these various texts of Madame de Maintenon into a series of manuscript collections, the last and largest of which date from 1740. In addition, a massive correspondence of over five thousand letters written by Maintenon has survived. Théophile Lavallée’s multi-volume edition of Maintenon’s writings (1854-66) remains the most thorough print edition of Maintenon, but we remain far from a complete – let alone a critical – edition of her works.

Of particular philosophical importance are the writings where Maintenon treats ethical issues, especially the nature of virtue and vice. Her Entretiens are conferences with the Saint-Cyr faculty in which Maintenon emphasizes the formation in virtue that is the principal end of education at the school. Her Instructions are addresses to the students in which she censures the typical vices and exalts the ideal virtues of the student body. Her Conversations (dialogues) are brief morality plays that define and illustrate the major virtues the student must inculcate. Maintenon’s approach to ethics is gendered inasmuch as she redefines the virtues and vices, originally defined in terms of male experience, in the framework of typical women’s experience. Her approach is also class-conscious, since she attempts to redefine the virtues in the perspective of women who are simultaneously aristocratic and impoverished.

3. Philosophical Themes

The primary philosophical interest of Maintenon’s works lies in its treatment of two related topics: educational theory and virtue theory. For Maintenon, the primary goal of education is the formation of the moral character of the pupil, interpreted according to the canons of Counter-reformational Catholicism. The secondary goal is vocational formation. In the case of Saint-Cyr, it is the development of the skills and the moral habits of the pupil who faces the future as a member of the impoverished, provincial nobility. Maintenon transforms the nature of moral virtue according to the demands of gender and social class. Traditionally masculine virtues, such as courage, are redefined to serve as the ideal ethical traits of the industrious wife largely confined to the domestic sphere. Virtues typical of the aristocratic class, notably politeness and civility, are raised to the status of primary moral dispositions.

a. Philosophy of Education

In her addresses to the faculty of Saint-Cyr, Maintenon sketches her philosophy of education. The ends of education are traditional: the formation of moral character for a Catholic member of the provincial aristocracy. But the dialogical methods of pedagogy championed by Maintenon exhibit a distinctive modernity.

Of Solid Education explains the educational end of Saint-Cyr for the faculty: “You [the teachers] apply yourself to developing the piety, the reason, and the morals of your girls. You inspire in them the love and practices of all virtues proper to them now and in the future.” Maintenon insists that the virtue to be cultivated and the means used to achieve this ethical culture must always be “reasonable,” but this reasonableness is of a practical rather than speculative nature. Of the Education of Young Ladies specifies how this practical reasonableness differs from erudition or aesthetic achievement: “You [the teachers] should concern yourself less with furnishing their mind than with forming their reason. Obviously, this approach provides less occasion for the knowledge and skill of the schoolmistress to sparkle. A young woman who has memorized a thousand things impresses her family and friends more than does a girl who simply knows how to exercise her judgment, when to be silent, how to be modest and reserved, how to avoid rushing into showing what she thinks about something.” This pedagogical ideal of practical reasonableness underscores the primacy Maintenon accords the virtues of discretion and restraint for aristocratic women, who are often plunged into dangerous political controversies. It also expresses the mature Maintenon’s disillusionment with the aesthetic and mystical ideals that had earlier served as the educational end of Saint-Cyr.

To maintain the moral atmosphere of the school, Maintenon insists on a strict regime of censorship. In Of the Danger of Profane Books, she condemns the use of all books that lack explicit religious or moral utility. “I call profane all books that are not religious, even if they seem innocent, as soon as it is clear that they have no real usefulness. Teach your pupils to be extremely cautious in their reading. They should always prefer their needlework, housework, or their duties in their state of life to it. If they really want to read, ensure that they use carefully chosen books apt to nourish their faith, to cultivate their judgment, and to guide their morals.” Of the Proper Choice of Theatrical Pieces underlines the risk of heresy as well as of moral corruption run by too lenient a regime of literary surveillance: “Don’t you [the teachers] realize the ease with which you grant entry to these little booklets without preliminary approval exposes your pupils to the greatest dangers? If the Jansenists and the Quietists knew this weakness, they would immediately find the secret in order to spread their errors. They would flood you with pamphlets containing the maxims, phrases, and songs which they sell for practically nothing.” Theoretical instruction in the demands of virtue is insufficient for the actual cultivation of it. The personal moral modeling by the faculty and the strictly moral and religiously orthodox atmosphere maintained by the faculty in the school are essential for the successful maturation of the Saint-Cyr pupil along the lines of Maintenon’s practical reasonableness.

If character formation is the central goal of education, the teacher must engage in regular dialogue with her pupils. In her faculty addresses, Maintenon criticizes the tendency of teachers to use lectures and to overvalue the cultivation of the memory of their pupils. To assist in the perfection of moral character, the schoolmistress should regularly engage in conversation with her pupils. Of the Education of Ladies argues that teacher-pupil dialogue should occur outside as well as inside the classroom: “On occasion you [the teachers] should be ready to chat informally with your pupils. This will help the pupils to love and trust you. You can acquire an influence over them that will prove beneficial.” The pupil is not to remain passive in this dialogue. The teacher can function as an accurate spiritual director only if the pupil discloses her actual moral struggles and achievements: “Sometimes you [the teachers] should let them express their will so that you may understand their basic dispositions. You then more accurately teach them the differences between the good, the evil, and the morally indifferent.” Maintenon’s insistence on a dialogical method of instruction reflects the value placed on refined conversation in the aristocratic circles of the period; it also expresses the conviction that the pedagogy of moral formation cannot succeed if the moral tutor has not gauged the actual moral temperament of the pupil as the tutor guides her to the school’s ideal of ethical maturity.

b. Virtue Theory

In several works Maintenon analyzes the four cardinal virtues: justice, fortitude, prudence, and temperance. Strikingly, whereas most philosophers would name justice as the most important virtue, Maintenon prizes temperance as the central virtue in a moral character. Without the restraining hand of temperance, the other virtues would quickly deteriorate into rigorism, foolhardiness, or fearfulness.

In the dialogue On the Cardinal Virtues, Maintenon defends this primacy of temperance in the ensemble of virtues. At the beginning of the dialogue, Justice presents its traditional claim as the preeminent virtue: “There is nothing as beautiful as Justice. It always has truth beside it. It judges without bias. It puts everything into order. It knows how to condemn its friends and to honor the rights of its enemies. It can even condemn itself. It only honors what is worthy of honor.” But the other cardinal virtues soon manifest their eminence over justice by demonstrating why and how the virtue of justice must be subordinated to them in order for justice to actually achieve its social ends. Prudence prevents justice from acting in too brusque a manner. “I [prudence] regulate its [justice’s] operations, prevent it from precipitation, make it take its time.” Similarly, fortitude strengthens justice when justice hesitates to execute proper punishment on a friend. “You [justice] need me [fortitude] because your sense of affection makes you find it difficult to inflict any pain on a friend.” While justice can determine where to assign just dessert, the execution of this determination requires the conjugated virtues of prudence and fortitude to avoid the distortions of severity or pusillanimity.

Standing above prudence and fortitude is the virtue of temperance. It imposes itself as the central virtue inasmuch as it prevents the other virtues from deteriorating into their customary excesses. “I destroy gluttony and excess. I tolerate no outbursts. Not only am I opposed to all evil; I moderate all good. Without me, Justice would be intolerable to human weakness, Fortitude would drive us to despair, Prudence would often prevent us from taking the actions we should and make waste our time weighing every option. But with me, Justice acquires a capacity for circumspection, Fortitude acquires suppleness, and Prudence continues to provide advice, but now without undue hesitation, without too much or too little haste. In a word, I am the remedy to all forms of extremism.” The primacy accorded temperance in the hierarchy of virtue parallels the emphasis accorded the values of discretion and good reputation in the education provided at Saint-Cyr.

Even the virtues of religion must subordinate themselves to the empire of temperance. Exercises of piety are to be commended only to the extent that they reflect the moderation and sobriety typical of the virtue of temperance. “I [temperance] must temper a religious zeal that is too busy, too emotional, and indiscreet. I have to encourage conduct that avoids extremes. I moderate both the inclination to give alms and the inclination to hoard money. I moderate the length of prayer, ascetical practices, recollection, silence, and good works. I shorten a sermon, a spiritual dialogue, or an examination of conscience.” Echoing Méré’s portrait of the honnête homme, Maintenon’s moral ideal of the student is the woman who subjects all thought and action to the moderating influence of temperance. Neither the mystic nor the activist represents Maintenon’s ideal of the moral agent who distinguishes herself through the modesty and emotional restraint with which she serves her neighbor.

c. Virtue and Gender

Given her exclusively feminine public of students and faculty, Maintenon often transforms the nature of the virtues in order to accommodate the sex-specific experience of women of the period. Her gendered transformation of virtue is apparent in her analysis of three particular virtues: courage, glory, and eminence.

The dramatic dialogue On Courage demonstrates how women as well as men are required to cultivate the virtue of courage. At the beginning of the dialogue, Faustine insists that courage is not proper for women. “Courage is not having any fear. This type of achievement is not for our sex.” Victoria counters that, although women are not called to cultivate the martial courage proper to men, there are other types of courage necessary to women. “Certainly courage is opposed to fear. But there is more than one kind of fear. It is not necessary for us to cultivate the courage that makes someone go to war or be willing to risk his life.” It is precisely the pupils and alumnae of Saint-Cyr who illustrate the type of courage proper to women. Courage within the school manifests itself in the diligence with which one executes the duties of the school day. “There are those who joyfully fulfill all their duties and who are first in everything. They love work, they want to please their teachers, and they want to do even more than one asks of them.” Saint-Cyr alumnae express this gendered courage by enduring the constraints of the impoverished life of the provincial aristocracy. Emily muses about “the poverty we may find in the future and the foul character of those with whom we will have to deal. They very well might criticize without the moderation we are accustomed to here [at Saint-Cyr].” Distinct from the courage of the warrior, the courage of women presents itself as the capacity to endure academic and domestic obstacles in the patient pursuit of one’s personal vocation as student or mistress of the manor.

Similarly, glory is redefined away from its traditionally masculine framework of military prowess or political preeminence. For Maintenon, glory is a matter of personal integrity that could manifest itself as easily in domestic work as in military or political achievement. The address On True Glory defines glory as a species of personal honor: “I believe that true glory consists in loving one’s honor and in never performing any base action.” Maintenonian glory is clearly gendered. It not only includes the refusal of any major sin; it encompasses the refusal of typical female indiscretions, such as flirtation, receiving gifts from men, or accepting letters from men unknown to the addressee. The address insists that glory is not a biological category, reposing on one’s familial descent; it is a type of integrity and self-reliance allied to hard work. “There is much more nobility in living from one’s work and from one’s savings than in being a burden to one’s friends….I wouldn’t tell rich people to sell their needlework, but I would tell those who aren’t so rich to do so.” Rather than being tied to distinguished public achievement, glory emerges as a simple preeminence in the practice of sacrificial virtues of service. “We ordinarily recognize glory by its honesty and even by its humility, by its concern to give pleasure to others, to relieve pain, to avoid giving offense, and to render service.” Freed from its traditional accoutrements of wealth, military valor, and social prominence, the redefined virtue of glory can now be cultivated as easily by impoverished women as it is by others.

In the dialogue On Eminence, Maintenon redefines the aristocratic virtue of eminence to include the experience of impoverished but industrious women. The dialogue denies that eminence consists in social rank or economic fortune; on the contrary, authentic eminence consists in an unusual degree of self-mastery. “True eminence consists in esteeming virtue alone, in knowing how to distance ourselves from fortune when it turns against us and how to avoid being intoxicated by fortune when it turns our way. It consists in sharing the destiny of the unfortunate and in never holding them in contempt.” In this fusion of neo-Stoic and Christian theories of virtue, eminence denotes both volitional equilibrium and sacrificial love of the suffering neighbor. The dialogue also insists that authentic eminence must be acquired through personal merit and struggle, not conferred by family descent or inherited wealth. “There are different types of nobility. We have to see ourselves as we are. We should only raise ourselves up through our own merit. That is where we find true eminence.” Paralleling her own controversial career in the French court, Maintenonian eminence subverts a social hierarchy of rank based on biological inheritance and exalts moral and social distinction acquired through tenacious personal endeavor.

d. Virtue and Class

Addressing an aristocratic public, Maintenon devotes particular attention to two virtues prized by court society: politeness and civility.

The address On Politeness insists on the central value of good manners to be cultivated by the pupils at Saint-Cyr. “Since God has made you ladies by birth, have a lady’s manners. May those of you who have been properly raised by your parents retain these manners and may the others soon acquire them.” Maintenon details the components of noble comportment: refined language, upright posture, discreet gestures. But Maintenon politeness does not limit itself to a code of external conduct; it is ultimately an interior disposition of respect toward all persons whom the mature aristocrat encounters: “Whatever you say or do, be careful to avoid giving offense or embarrassment to anyone.” The purpose of external polite conduct is to express sensitivity toward the feelings and dignity of others. Maintenon repeatedly reminds her pupils that this posture of reverence includes one’s servants and social inferiors as well as one’s peers and social superiors.

Complementing the virtue of politeness, the virtue of civility entails a spirit of sacrificial service toward all those with whom one interacts. The address On Civility presents this virtue as an ascetical attention to the interests and needs of others. “Civility involves freeing oneself in order to be busy about the needs of other people, in paying attention to what can help or hinder them, in order to do the former and to avoid the latter. Civility entails not talking about oneself, not making others listen too long to oneself, listening carefully to others, avoiding making conversation focus on oneself and one’s tastes, and permitting the conversation to move naturally toward the accommodation of other people’s interests.” Although civility includes the salon art of refined conversation, Maintenon presents the virtue as a refined species of humility, in which the concerns of others trump one’s own.

To clarify the nature of authentic civility, Maintenon appeals to the evangelical golden rule. “The Gospel firmly accords with the duties of a civil life. You know that Our Lord tells us that we should not do to others what we do not want others to do to us. This must be our great rule, which does not rule out certain customs traditional in our native lands.” Civility entails reciprocity, a recognition of the other persons one meets as one’s equal in dignity and in need. Although On Civility admits that the fluctuating customs of a particular culture may require one to show special deference toward those considered socially superior, Maintenonian civility is built on an egalitarian ethics of mutual respect.

4. Reception and Interpretation

The immediate posthumous reputation of Madame de Maintenon was a largely negative one. The memoirs of the courtier Louis de Rouvroy, duc de Saint-Simon (1675-1755), and the letters of Charlotte-Elisabeth of Bavaria, duchesse d’ Orléans (1652-1722), depicted Maintenon as a schemer who manipulated Louis XIV’s emotions of grief to achiever her power and then used that power to intensify the anti-Protestant policies of the throne. The publication of Maintenon’s alleged letters (1752) by the Huguenot writer Laurent Angliviel de La Beaumelle presented Maintenon as the hidden architect of Louis XIV’s Revocation of the Edict of Nantes and other persecutory measures. Subsequent discovery of the forged nature of the most incriminating letters in La Beaumelle’s collection did little to soften the image of Maintenon as a manipulative bigot, an image still present in Patricia Mazuy’s film Saint-Cyr (2000).

In the nineteenth-century, Théophile Lavallée’s multi-volume edition of the works of Maintenon (1854-66) presented the breadth and complexity of Maintenon’s extensive writings. Commentators began to note Maintenon’s skill as a moraliste, an analyst of the conflicting interplay of virtue and vice in the human constitution. In the late nineteenth-century, educational officials of the French Third Republic attempted to foster public high school education for women through the new institution of the lycée. Maintenon’s addresses and dialogues seemed perfectly suited for an adolescent female public cultivating the virtues necessary for citizenship. The anthologies of Maintenon’s texts assembled by Cadet (1885), Faguet (1885), Geoffroy (1887), and Jacquinet (1888) were textbooks designed for the new lycée. But these anthologies presented an oddly areligious Maintenon, carefully denatured by the anti-clerical Third Republic. References to God, religion, and piety were often censored out of her texts; only the more secular virtues survived.

Recent studies of Maintenon have attempted to present a more positive evaluation of Maintenon as a philosopher. Madeleine Daniélou’s study of Maintenon’s educational theories and practices (1948) underscores her innovations as an educational philosopher and the theological foundations of that philosophy. John Conley’s English translation of and commentary on Maintenon (2004) describes the complexity of her moral psychology, especially in her account of virtue and freedom. Other commentators, however, notably Carolyn Lougee (1976) and Carlo François (1987), lament that Maintenon’s educational experiments and theories still confined women to the spheres of the household and of the convent.

5. References and Further Reading

All French to English translations were made by the author of this article.

Primary Sources

Maintenon, Françoise d’Aubigné, marquise de Maintenon. Conseils et instructions aux demoiselles pour leur conduite dans le monde. Ed. Théophile Lavallée. 2 vols. Paris: Charpentier, 1857.
- [Still the standard edition of the major works of Maintenon composed for pupils at Saint-Cyr.]
Maintenon, Françoise d’Aubigné, marquise de Maintenon . Lettres et entretiens sur l’éducation des filles. Ed. Théophile Lavallée. 2 vols. Paris: Charpentier, 1854.
- [A collection of letters and addresses dealing with issues of education.]
Maintenon, Françoise d’Aubigné, marquise de Maintenon. Extraits de ses Lettres, Avis, Entretiens, Conversations et Proverbes. 4^th ed. Ed. Octave Gréard. Paris: Hachette, 1886.
- [This anthology of Maintenon’s texts is available online at Gallica, bibliothéque numérique, on the website of the Bibliothèque nationale de France.]
Maintenon, Françoise d’Aubigné, marquise de Maintenon. Comment la sagesse vient aux filles. Eds. Pierre-E. Leroy and Marcel Loyau. Etrepilly: Batrillat, 1998.
- [Extensive contemporary anthology of Maintenon texts dealing with education.]
Maintenon, Françoise d’Aubigné, marquise de Maintenon. Dialogues and Addresses. Trans. and ed. John Conley. Other Voice Series. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 2004.
- [Contemporary English translation of Maintenon’s major educational texts, accompanied by philosophical commentary.]

Secondary Sources

Castelot, André. Madame de Maintenon: La reine secrète. Paris: Perrin, 1996.
- [A sympathetic study of the political role of Maintenon.]
Conley, John. The Suspicion of Virtue: Women Philosophers in Neoclassical France. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press, 2002. pp. 124-56.
- [A philosophical analysis of Maintenon’s educational and moral theories.]
Daniélou, Madeleine. Madame de Maintenon, éducatrice. Paris: Bloud & Gay, 1946.
- [A sympathetic rehabilitation of the educational philosophy and theology of Maintenon.]
François, Carlo. Précieuses et autres indociles: Aspects du féminisme dans la littérature française du XVIIe siècle. Birmingham, AL: Summa Publications, 1987.
- [A critical treatment of Maintenon’s work as antifeminist.]
Le Nabour, Eric. La Porteuse d’ombre: Madame de Maintenon et le Roi-Soleil. Paris: Tallandier, 1999.
- [A biography focusing on the role of Maintenon in the court politics at Versailles.]
Lougee, Carolyn. Le paradis des femmes: Women, Salons, and Social Stratification in Seventeenth-Century France. Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press, 1976.
- [A critical study of Maintenon’s school at Saint-Cyr compared with other period experiments in education of women.]

Author information

John J. Conley
jconley1@loyola.edu
Loyola University of Maryland

Incarnation

In the Bible‘s fourth gospel, John tells us “the Word [God the Son] became flesh [incarnate] and dwelt among us” (John 1: 14). The central claim of Christianity is that Jesus of Nazareth was none other than God the Son, who while remaining fully divine, took on a human nature for the sake of our salvation. Philosophical puzzles and problems arise as soon as we begin to unpack these notions. The humans we know best, ourselves, make moral mistakes, have trouble bench pressing three hundred pounds, and lose their car keys. We are morally flawed beings lacking in both power and knowledge. God, on the other hand, is typically understood to be morally perfect, all-knowing and all-powerful. If being truly human includes moral failure and limitations in knowledge and power, and being truly divine requires moral perfection, along with perfect knowledge and power, then the incarnation runs afoul of the law of non-contradiction. This law, which Aristotle calls the most certain principle, states that nothing can both be and not be at the same time and in the same respect (Metaphysics, Bk. IV, Part 3). And so, neither Jesus of Nazareth, nor anyone or anything else, can simultaneously have a property (for example, be all-powerful) and lack it (for example, be limited in power).

The apparent conflict between the law of non-contradiction and the metaphysical claim that one person, Jesus of Nazareth, is both human and divine is not news to philosophers of religion. Some of the best philosophical minds in the past and present have wrestled with this problem. Four approaches stand out. Beginning with the most radical approach, some simply reject the law of non-contradiction. If the incarnation runs afoul of the law non-contradiction, so much the worse for that law. Less radically, one might argue that identity is not an all-or-nothing affair, and hold that there is a significant sense in which Jesus of Nazareth and God the Son could be identical without having all of the same properties. In technical terms, making this move requires giving up a principle called the indiscernibility of identicals in favor of a relative account of identity. If, by affirming relative identity, one could hold that Jesus of Nazareth is identical to God the Son, even though they do not have all the same properties, one could affirm both the incarnation and the law of non-contradiction.

Many philosophers have argued that one need not appeal to relative identity to reconcile the incarnation with the law of non-contradiction. Here there are two approaches to consider. First, some argue that the incarnation appears to flout this law because we have misunderstood the kinds of properties required for being truly human and/or truly divine. Second, some hold that the incarnation seems to run afoul of the law of non-contradiction because we have failed to see the way in which God the Son Incarnate possesses properties and their complements. Only if the incarnation required that God the Son Incarnate both be and not be at the same time and in the same respect, would it be incompatible with the law of non-contradiction. The doctrine does not require this, and therefore is completely compatible with the law of non-contradiction. This article considers these various responses to the philosophical problem of incarnation.

The Historical Framework
The Incompatibility Problem
Responses to the Incompatibility Problem
Conclusion
References and Further Reading

1. The Historical Framework

The word “Incarnation” derives from the Latin (in + carnis), which means “in the flesh.” Philosophers writing on the incarnation invariably refer to the classical or orthodox view of the incarnation, and here they have in mind the Chalcedonian Creed (451 [MP1]). Stephen T. Davis is typical: “This is the dogma (the Chalcedonian Creed) I have been calling the classical doctrine of the incarnation. It constituted something of a consensus in Christendom from the time of Chalcedon until recently” (Davis, 2006, 99). The creed defines what it means for God the Son to be incarnate, but does so in a way that allows for considerable metaphysical latitude. In the words of C. Stephen Evans, “This formulation at Chalcedon does not attempt a theoretical understanding of what it means for Jesus of Nazareth to be God Incarnate; it simply lays down some boundaries for what is to count as an orthodox Christian understanding of Jesus’ status” (Evans, 2006a,1 ).

In order to stay within the confines of orthodoxy, metaphysical accounts of the incarnation must preserve Jesus Christ’s divinity, humanity, and identity with God the Son. In other words, they must be compatible with three theses:

1) Jesus Christ is truly divine; in the language of Chalcedon: “. . . the same perfect in Godhead . . . truly God . . . consubstantial with the Father in Godhead” (Olson, 1999, 231).

2) Jesus Christ is truly human; in the words of the creed: “. . . the same in perfect manhood . . . truly man, the same of a rational soul and body. . .consubstantial with us in manhood; like us in all things except sin. . . ” (Olson, 1999, 231).

3) Jesus Christ is a single individual identical to God the Son; in the words of Chalcedon: “. . . made known in two natures without confusion, without change, without division, without separation; the difference of the natures being by no means removed because of the union but rather the property of each nature being preserved, and coalescing in one person (prosopon) and one hypostasis, not parted or divided into two persons, but one and the same Son, only-begotten, the divine Word, the Lord Jesus Christ . . . ” (Olson, 1999, 231-232).

We would do well to keep these three theses in mind as we consider “Responses to the Incompatibility Problem.” Insofar as a response emphasizes the distinction between the human and divine, the third thesis will be most relevant for its evaluation. For responses that emphasize a reconsideration of the properties required for being truly human, the second thesis will be most pertinent for an assessment of it. And, as an approach focuses on a reconsideration of the constitutive properties of divinity, the first thesis is the most important one for its evaluation.

Finally, it is important to note some of the views these theses rule out. Arius (250-336), bishop of Alexandria, taught that the Son is “God’s perfect creature” (Olson, 146) and therefore a lesser being than God the Father. Arian views deny the full divinity of God the Son and therefore are incompatible with the first thesis. Apollinarius, a 4th-century bishop of Laodicea, denied that God the Son Incarnate possessed a human mind as well as a human body. Apollinarian views deny the full humanity of God the Son Incarnate and therefore are incompatible with the second thesis. Nestorianism, taking its name from Nestorius, a 5th-century bishop of Constantinople, holds that in God the Son Incarnate there are two persons, one human and one divine, and is therefore incompatible with the third thesis.

2. The Incompatibility Problem

According to the classical account of the incarnation, Jesus Christ is truly human, truly divine, and a single individual who is identical to God the Son. Suppose that, as a matter of fact, Jesus of Nazareth worked as a carpenter, went fishing on the Sea of Galilee, and was unpopular with some civil and religious leaders. Things could have gone differently. Conceivably, Jesus might have been a potter who never set foot on the beaches of Galilee, and was unknown to the movers and shakers of his time. Either way he would have been truly human.

Characteristics or properties relating to employment, popularity, trips to the sea, and the like are compatible with being human but not essential for having that status. Just what properties are essential for being truly human is, as we shall see, a topic of considerable debate.

John Hick counts limited power and knowledge among the plausible candidates and argues that this spells trouble for the adherent of the Chalcedonian account of the incarnation, for the complements of these properties, unlimited knowledge and power, are essential for being truly divine.

. . . there is an obvious puzzle as to how the same being can jointly
embody those attributes of God and of humanity that are apparently
incompatible. God is eternal, whilst humans have a beginning in time;
God is infinite, humans finite; God is the creator of the universe,
including humanity, whilst humans are part of God’s creation; God is
omnipotent, omniscient, omnipresent, whilst humans are limited in power
and knowledge and have a bounded location; and so on. Let us call this
the incompatible-attributes problem (Hick, 1993,102).

The worry, then, is that the classic account of the incarnation is flawed in the most fundamental sense; it runs counter to what Aristotle called the most certain principle: nothing can both be and not be at the same time and in the same respect (Metaphysics, Bk. IV, Part 3). If being truly human and being truly divine are indeed incompatible, then Jesus could no more have fulfilled the conditions of the Chalcedonian account of the incarnation than he could have been a spherical cube.

3. Responses to the Incompatibility Problem

a. Rejecting the Law of Non-contradiction

Toward the end of his journal, A Grief Observed, C.S. Lewis asks “Can a mortal ask questions which God finds unanswerable?” and readily replies in the affirmative.

Quite easily, I should think. All nonsense questions are unanswerable.
How many hours are there in a mile? Is yellow square or round? Probably
half of the questions we ask─half our great theological and metaphysical
problems─are like that (Lewis, 1961, 81).

Though there is no reason to think that Lewis had questions about the incarnation in mind, one could respond to the objection that the Chalcedonian account of the incarnation runs counter to the law of non-contradiction, by arguing that this law no more applies to the incarnation than geometric properties do to colors. Asking if God the Son’s human nature is compatible with his divine nature, would be like asking if purple is perpendicular. It is what philosophers call ‘a category mistake,’ the error of applying concepts and distinctions to subjects where they have no purchase. In this regard, Thomas V. Morris cites H. M. Relton as asserting that “the person of Christ is the bankruptcy of human logic;” Soren Kierkegaard (1813-1855) as holding that the incarnation is “a breach with all thinking,” and notes Gareth Moore’s reference to those for whom “The doctrine of the incarnation expressed a divine mystery which we mere mortals could not expect to understand, and it was bordering on the blasphemous for any feeble, logic-chopping human intellect to attack it” (Morris, 1986, 24-25).

To evaluate rejecting the law of non-contradiction, as a response to the charge that some essential human and divine properties are incompatible, let’s assume, for the sake of the argument, that the law does not apply to the incarnation. Since it tells us that nothing can both be and not be at the same time and in the same respect, making our assumption amounts to holding that God the Son could possess any property (for example, having unlimited power) and its complement (for example, having limited power).

If this were so, there could not be any problem with God the Son being truly human and truly divine, no matter how we understand ‘humanity’ and ‘divinity.’ But the same problem-free possibility would also go for God the Son being truly divine and incarnate as a doorknob, the number seven or a piece of toast. Furthermore, apart from the law of non-contradiction, God the Son Incarnate could both have any property (for example, being human) and its complement (for example, not being human), at the same time and in the same respect. However, if having a property does not rule out its absence, then all property distinctions (for example, being incarnate and not being incarnate) break down. As such, doing away with the law of non-contradiction, in order to defend the doctrine of the incarnation, leads to the loss all meaningful property distinctions, and the significance of theological assertions. What we need is a way to work within the metaphysical constraints of Chalcedon, not a way to shake them off altogether.

b. Rejecting the All-or-Nothing Account of Identity in Favor of Relative Identity

Our first attempt to address the incompatibility problem plaguing the Chalcedonian account of the incarnation ─ rejecting the law of non-contradiction ─ led to the breakdown of meaningful property distinctions. A less radical approach for responding to the incompatibility problem requires a fresh look at the concept of identity. So far, in our reasoning, we have assumed that Jesus of Nazareth could be identical to God the Son only if Jesus possessed every property had by God the Son, and vice versa. In doing so, we have supposed that identity is an all-or-nothing affair. This view of identity is expressed in a principle Leibniz called the indiscernibility of identicals:

For any property P and any persons X and Y, if X is identical with Y then X has P if and only if Y has P (cf. Plantinga, 1976, 15).

Given both the law of non-contradiction and the indiscernibility of identicals, it is difficult indeed to see how Jesus of Nazereth could be identical to God the Son. Suppose Jesus is limited in power and God the Son is essentially all-powerful. The law of non-contradiction rules out the possibility of Jesus having both unlimited and limited power, and also the possibility of God the Son having both limited and unlimited power. But, the indiscernibility of identicals requires Jesus to have unlimited power in order to be identical to God the Son, and God the Son to have limited power in order to be identical to Jesus. It seems, then, that an acceptance of both the law of non-contradiction and the indiscernibility of identicals rules out the Chalcedonian view that a single individual can be both truly divine and truly human. So, if we want to affirm Chalcedon and retain the law of non-contradiction, it makes sense to consider rejecting the all-or-nothing account of identity expressed by the indiscernibility of identicals.

Some suggest that instead of thinking of identity as sameness in all respects, as in the indiscernibility of identicals, we should think of it as sameness in just some respects. On this account of identity, relative identity, two things, X and Y, can be identical in some respects but not others. So, for example, Senator Barack Obama and President Barack Obama are the same person but not the same official. As an official, Senator Barack Obama is a member of the legislative branch of government, while President Barack Obama, as an official, is a member of the executive branch of government.

The qualifiers in the Obama example, “person” and “official,” are count nouns, nouns we can modify numerically. It makes sense to speak of two persons or officials, but not of two courages or honesties. It follows, then, that while “person” and “official” are count nouns, “courage” and “honesty” are not.

For our present purposes, let’s suppose that Jesus of Nazareth is the same person as God the Son, but the two differ relative to X, where X does duty for some count noun. Let’s suppose that, relative to this count noun, Jesus is limited in knowledge and power and the like, and therefore not all-powerful and all-knowing, while God the Son is all-powerful and all-knowing and the like, and so not limited in power and knowledge.

Such an interpretation seems to be necessary if an appeal to relative identity is to show that Jesus of Nazareth and God the Son can be identical, notwithstanding property differences. However, it requires attributing essential human properties, like limited power, to Jesus but not God the Son, and essential divine properties, like unlimited knowledge, to God the Son but not Jesus of Nazareth. As a result, it is hard to see how an appeal to relative identity can be compatible with Chalcedon’s requirement that the divine and human natures be “. . . without division, without separation . . . coalescing in one person (prosopon) and one hypostasis. . . “(Olson, 1999, 231), in keeping with the third Chalcedonian thesis.

c. Reconsidering the Properties Required for Being Truly Human and/or Truly Divine

It is easy to assume, along with John Hick, that to be truly human God the Son had to be limited in knowledge and power, and, in general, possess the complements of essential divine properties. However, if Hick’s assumptions were unwarranted, then the doctrine of the incarnation would be perfectly compatible with the law of non-contradiction. We should then at least entertain the possibility that incompatibility problems show that our assumptions about the essential properties of humanity and/or divinity are incorrect.

i. Reconsidering the Properties Required for Being Truly Human

1) Thomas V. Morris’s Distinctions Between Essential and Common Properties, and Full and Mere Humanity

Thomas V. Morris challenges our assumptions regarding the properties necessary for being truly human. He does so, by drawing our attention to two crucial─but commonly overlooked─distinctions. First, Morris asks us to consider the distinction between being fully but not merely X, and being fully and merely X. For example, a cube, like a two-dimensional square, is fully a rectangle, as each one of the cube’s faces is a parallelogram with four right angles. However, a cube is not merely a rectangle, for it possesses a higher-level property; it is three-dimensional. A diamond-backed rattlesnake, like a diamond, is fully physical; it has a spatiotemporal location. But, a rattlesnake is not merely physical for it possesses higher-level properties diamonds lack, for example, cellular composition and voluntary motion. Similarly, God the Son Incarnate is fully but not merely human. He has all of the properties individually necessary and jointly sufficient for being human, but also higher-level divine properties.

Second, Morris draws our attention to the distinction between properties commonly possessed by humans and properties essential to humanity. By definition, if a property is essential for being human, all humans must have it. So, essential human properties are necessarily common human properties. However, the reverse does not hold. A property can be common without being essential. Breaking promises is a common human property but is not thereby an essential human property. God the Son’s genuine humanity would not have been jeopardized by his faithfully fulfilling all of his promises.

Further, if we neglect these distinctions, we may incorrectly assume that properties commonly possessed by those who are merely human are necessary for being fully human. Morris thinks that this is exactly what we have done. We have assumed that the properties commonly possessed by mere humans, for example, limited knowledge and power, are necessary for being fully human. Once we see that this is not so, the incarnation is no longer an affront to the law of non-contradiction.

Morris’s approach is bold and intriguing. Whether or not it is ultimately satisfactory, depends upon the strength of responses to the concerns it raises. First, if we allow, for the sake of the argument, that properties like limited knowledge and power are not essential for being fully human, we might well ask, “What are essential?” In response, Morris takes a wait-and-see approach, “What essentially constitutes a human body and a human mind we wait upon a perfected science or a more complete revelation to say. We have neither a very full-blown nor a very fine-grained understanding of either at this point” (Morris, 1991, 166).

Second, we might ask “if properties like limited power and knowledge are not essential for being fully human, why are they so common?” Morris suggests that what makes these properties so common is either that they are included in our individual human natures, or they are the result of being merely human, that is, not possessing some additional nature (Morris, 1991, 165). Thus, the reason why Thomas V. Morris ─ and the rest of us ─ is limited in power and knowledge is either that his human nature is not possessed along with some higher nature, or because his individual nature ─ the properties essential for being the particular human that is Thomas V. Morris ─ includes limitations in power and knowledge.

There is a third concern. Morris rightly recognizes that an internally consistent account of the incarnation is not the only desideratum; he also wants an account that squares with the New Testament portrait of Jesus of Nazareth. Morris must explain how it is that God the Son Incarnate could be, as described in the gospels, limited in power and knowledge (for example, Mark 13:32; John 4:6), even though he remained omnipotent and omniscient. Morris’s answer is that God the Son Incarnate had both a divine and human mind, and sometimes chose to rely only upon the resources of his human mind.

. . . in the case of God Incarnate we must recognize something like two distinct minds or systems of mentality. There is first what we can call the eternal mind of God the Son, with its distinctively divine consciousness . . . encompassing the full scope of omniscience, empowered by the resources of omnipotence, and present in power and knowledge throughout the entirety of the creation. And, in addition to this divine mind, there is a distinctly earthly mind with its consciousness that came into existence and developed with the conception, human birth and growth of Christ’s earthly form of existence. . . . By living out his earthly life from on the resources of the human body and mind, he took on the form of our existence and shared the plight of our condition (Morris, 1991, 169).

Talk of two minds inevitably raises the specter of two persons and Nestorianism. On a Cartesian view of persons, a human mind is a human person. From this perspective, if the incarnation required both a divine mind and human mind, then in God the Son Incarnate there were two persons, one human and one divine. Morris is aware of the concern and grants that in the case of mere humans, a human mind is a human person, “What we can refer to as my mental system was intended by God to define a person” (Morris, 1991, 174). However, for God incarnate, one who is fully human, but not merely human, having a human mind is not sufficient for being a human person. That individual’s personhood depends upon his ultimate metaphysical status, in this case divinity (Morris, 1991, 174).

2) Richard Swinburne’s Rejection of a Human Mind/Soul in Favor of a Human Range of Consciousness

At the core of Richard Swinburne’s account of the incarnation is the claim that God the Son Incarnate has both a human range of consciousness and a divine range of consciousness. In this way his view is akin to Thomas V. Morris’s. However, there is a crucial difference between their accounts. Morris holds that God the Son Incarnate has two minds, a divine mind and a human mind, each with its own range of consciousness.

Swinburne argues that God the Son Incarnate has a single mind with two ranges of consciousness. Instead of Morris’s two-minds view of the incarnation, Swinburne offers a divided-mind account of the incarnation.

To understand what Swinburne’s divided-mind view amounts to and why he prefers it to Morris’s two-minds view, we need to consider his understanding of humanity. In general, a mental substance, that is, a soul/mind, is human if it has a human body and is capable of “acting, acquiring beliefs, sensations and desires through it” (Swinburne, 1994, 196). Note that on this view, a mental substance is human only if it has a human body.

Richard Swinburne and the rest of us are human. But, by Swinburne’s reckoning, we are not essentially so. This follows from the fact that having a human body is a necessary condition for being human, and it is conceivable that we exist either without a body or with a very different sort of body. But, while no soul is essentially human, one soul became human by choice.

In taking on a human body and acquiring a human range of consciousness, God the Son did not lose omnipotence or omniscience. Indeed, he could not do so, for he is essentially divine, and omnipotence and omniscience belong to the divine nature. Instead, by becoming human, God the Son acquired additional ways of accessing the world; he took on “a way of operating which is limited and feels limited” (Swinburne, 1989, 66). So, we can explain references in the gospels to God the Son’s ignorance and powerlessness, as the results of the Son only relying on his human range of consciousness and abilities.

Because of his divided-mind account of the incarnation, Richard Swinburne steers clear of Nestorianism, for without two minds there cannot be two persons. That said, some may worry that without two minds, there cannot be two natures. If this is so, then Swinburne’s divided-mind view of the incarnation avoids Nestorianism only by taking an Apollinarian position in which God the Son incarnate has a human body but lacks a human mind.

Swinburne is well aware of the apparent problem and has a ready response. His view would be Apollinarian, if, in their talk about taking on a “reasonable soul,” the Fathers of Chalcedon had wished to affirm that God the Son took on an immaterial substance, a Cartesian soul so to speak. But that could not have been their view for then they would have been committed to a position they expressly denied, namely, that in the incarnation there are two beings. Instead, we should understand “soul” in the creed’s reference to “reasonable soul,” in an Aristotelian sense. So understood, to say that God the Son took on a human soul is to claim that he acquired “a human way of thinking and acting” (Swinburne, 1989, 61, note 12). If this reading of Chalcedon is correct, then Swinburne’s account does not entail Apollinarianism.

ii. Reconsidering the Properties Required for Being Truly Divine: the Kenotic Approach

The counterpart to reconsidering what properties are essential to humanity is a reexamination of the properties essential to divinity. If we have reason to believe ─ contrary to Thomas V. Morris’s suggestion ─ that limited knowledge and power are not just common human properties but essential ones, consistency requires that we no longer count omnipotence and omniscience as essential divine properties. There is data in the New Testament that would support revising the list of essential divine properties. The New Testament records tell us that God the Son was sometimes tired (John 4:6) and that he grew in wisdom (Luke 2:52). When these descriptions are considered along side of Philippians 2:7, which tells us that God the Son “emptied himself” in order to become incarnate, it is reasonable to suppose that God the Son Incarnate relinquished properties such as omnipotence and omniscience. This approach to the incarnation is known as the kenotic view, in keeping with the Greek verb keneo, “to empty,” found in Philippians 2:7.

In order for God the Son to be able to give up properties like omnipotence and omniscience, two things need to be true. First, none of these properties could be essential properties of divinity, for God the Son is, by his very nature, divine, and no being can lose an essential property and continue to exist. Second, all of these properties, if possessed by God the Son, or another member of the Trinity, must be compatible with the essential properties of divinity, for God the Son can relinquish only what he can possess, and can possess only properties compatible with his divine nature.

It is important to distinguish God the Son’s relinquishing of properties like omniscience and omnipotence in the kenotic view, with the views of Morris and Swinburne on which God the Son chose not to avail himself of these properties for a period of time. For Morris and Swinburne, omnipotence and omniscience are essential divine properties and therefore ones that God the Son must always have. On the kenotic view these properties are accidental and therefore properties that God the Son can lose. On the kenotic view, there was a period of time during which God the Son could not possibly avail himself of omnipotence and omniscience (Evans, 2006b, 200).

If properties like omnipotence and omniscience are not essential divine properties, one might well ask: in what sense are power and knowledge essential to divinity? The kenotic response is that, it is not omnipotence but omnipotence unless freely given up, not omniscience but omniscience unless freely given up, that are essential properties of divinity. On the kenotic view, God the Son gives up the “omni properties” in order to become incarnate, while retaining the “unless properties.”

If “omni properties” are not essential for divinity, then God the Father and God the Holy Spirit could also give up omnipotence and omniscience. If all three persons of the Trinity did so simultaneously ─ and to the extent God the Son did at the beginning of the incarnation ─ there would be a time when many ordinary humans would surpass God in knowledge and power. This seems sufficient for a reductio ad absurdum of the kenotic view.

Ronald J. Feenstra sees the problematic nature of a complete Trinitarian kenosis, and so suggests a further refinement of essential divine properties, replacing omnipotence unless freely given up with omnipotence unless freely given up for the sake of reconciliation and omniscience unless freely given up with omniscience unless freely given up for the sake of reconciliation. Given this fine-tuning and an assumption that God the Son has accomplished the work of redemption, it would no longer be possible to have an absurd scenario in which many humans surpass all three members of the Trinity in knowledge and power (Feenstra, 2006, 153).

There would, however, be another problem: the kenotic approach would appear ad hoc, inviting the following question: “Apart from rescuing a Chalcedonian account of the incarnation, is there any reason to suppose that God has these fine-tuned kenotic properties?” In response, the kenotic theologian might argue, in keeping with Alvin Plantinga’s “Advice to Christian Philosophers” (Plantinga, 1984), that it is perfectly appropriate to begin with what we know about the incarnation and revise our concepts of God and humanity accordingly (Feenstra, 2006, 159).

By the same token, if there is a conflict between special revelation and the kenotic account of the incarnation, the latter must go. C. Stephen Evans, a defender of the kenotic approach, draws our attention to just such an apparent conflict concerning the glorification of God the Son Incarnate and expresses it in the form of a dilemma (Evans 2002, 263-264).

Either the glorified God the Son Incarnate reassumes the properties he set aside or not.
If so, these properties are compatible with God the Son’s incarnation, contrary to the kenotic view.
If not, the kenotic view has a deficient account of the glorification of God the Son Incarnate.
So, either the kenotic approach is incorrect in supposing that God the Son’s incarnation requires setting aside certain properties or it is committed to a deficient account of God the Son’s glorification.

In response to this dilemma, a kenotic defender could distinguish between incarnation and kenosis, and argue that while kenosis entails incarnation, the reverse is not true. It may be that kenosis was the means by which God the Son became incarnate and subsequently shared our trials and temptations (Feenstra 1989, 148-150). However, kenosis and incarnation are not co-extensive for, while God the Son’s kenosis ends at his glorification, his incarnation does not. Evans suggests that “. . . Christ’s Incarnation in an ordinary body may have required a kenosis, but the kind of body he possesses in his glorified state may be compatible with the reassumption of all of the traditional theistic properties” (Evans 206b., 201-202). If this is right, then limited power and knowledge are not essential human properties after all. The relevant essential properties are more fine-grained: being limited in power while having an ordinary (unglorified) human body, being limited in knowledge while having an ordinary (ungloried) human body and so forth. So, God the Son gave up the properties like omnipotence and omniscience, not because he had to do so to be truly human─or else the glorified Son of God would not be truly human─but because our redemption required it.

iii. Reconsidering the Properties Required for Being Truly Divine and Truly Human: Marilyn Adams’ Qualified-Property Approach

Marilyn Adams holds that, barring a miracle, every human individual is essentially human. In the miracle of the incarnation God the Son, who is essentially divine, acquires a human nature. As a result, God the Son is not only truly divine, but also truly human. However, since God the Son is not essentially human, none of the properties included in his human nature are among his essential properties.

In virtue of possessing a divine nature, God the Son has the property of being uncreated, while in virtue of having a human nature, he possesses the property of being created. Possessing both of these properties appears to be a violation of the law of non-contradiction, which tells us that nothing can both be and not be at the same time and in the same respect. Adams, however, taking her cue from Duns Scotus (1266-1308) (Adams, 2006, 133), argues that there is no incompatibility with the law of non-contradiction. As she sees it, strictly speaking, God the Son Incarnate does not possess the property pair: being created and being uncreated, but rather the pair: uncreated as (qua) divine and created as (qua) human. Further, since God the Son Incarnate is essentially divine and contingently human, he possesses the property of being uncreated, without qualification (simpliciter) and the property of being created, with qualification. Either way we choose to describe the difference between God the Son’s essential possession of his divine properties and contingent possession of his human properties, God the Son does not possess them in the same sense. Therefore there is no violation of the law of non-contradiction.

Adams goes on to note that Richard Cross (Cross, 2002, 204-205) “remains dubious” about this approach (Adams, 2006, 133). Chalcedon requires that God the Son Incarnate be “consubstantial with us in manhood; like us in all things except sin” (Olson, 1999, 231). However, what we possess is the property of being created, simpliciter, a property that God the Son Incarnate cannot possess as he has the property of being uncreated, simpliciter. It seems then that the distinction between properties God the Son Incarnate possesses with and without qualification, keeps the incarnation in line with the law of non-contradiction only by denying a core Chalcedonian claim – God the Son Incarnate is like us, save for sin. In response, Adams argues that the difficulty is only apparent, for the content of God the Son Incarnate’s human nature is the same as our nature; what differs is the way the content is attributed to him.

Commentators needlessly worry that if the Divine Word does not possess human nature in the way we do . . . in such a way that we could not exist without being human ─ then the Divine Word isn’t fully or perfectly human ─ i.e., doesn’t really possess all of what goes into being a human being. What the doctrine requires is that the Divine Word ─while essentially Divine ─ contingently come to possess human nature in such a way as to be characterized by such features. So far as I know, no one . . . has envisioned the Divine Word possessing human nature essentially in such a way that the Divine Word couldn’t exist without being human (Adams, 2006, 134).

d. Showing that God the Son Incarnate Does Not Possess Any Property and its Complement “in the same respect”: Eleonore Stump’s Borrowed-Property View

Given the law of non-contradiction, God the Son Incarnate cannot both have and lack a property at the same time and in the same respect. To see how God the Son might have a property in one respect, but lack it in another, it is helpful to consider some everyday examples of this sort of thing. An apple, with respect to its skin, has the property of being red, but, with respect to its whitish inside, lacks that property. So, the apple has and lacks the property of being red, but there is no incoherence here because the apple has that property in one respect and lacks it in another (Leftow, 1992, 288). Similarly, a knife, with respect to its cutting edge, has the property of being sharp, but with respect to its handle, lacks that property. So, the knife has and lacks the property of being sharp, but there is no incoherence here for the knife has this property in one respect, but lacks it in another.

On the classical view of the incarnation, God the Son Incarnate is truly human and truly divine. Some, John Hick for example, hold that there cannot be a truly human and truly divine individual because, for example, such a being would have to possess omnipotence, to be fully divine, and lack it, to be fully human. This would indeed be problematic if God the Son Incarnate had to have and lack omnipotence at the same time and in the same respect. However, given that God the Son Incarnate has two natures, he can have some properties with respect to one nature and lack them with respect to the other nature. God Incarnate, with respect to his divine nature, is omnipotent, but with respect to his human nature, is not. God Incarnate, with respect to his human nature, is ignorant of some things, but, with respect to his divine nature, is not.

There is a significant objection to this way of reconciling the classical account of the incarnation with the law of non-contradiction; it only avoids running afoul of the law of non-contradiction by, contrary to Chalcedon, “dividing the natures” of God Incarnate. If one must treat God Incarnate’s human and divine natures as watertight compartments in order to avoid contradiction, then one must also give up the Chalcedonian claim that the two natures combine in one person. Or, to put a positive spin on it, if one is going to appeal to God the Son’s natures to show that he can possess a property with respect to one nature but not another ─ and stay within the bounds of Chalcedon ─ one will need to show how a property can be had relative to a nature, without being had only by that nature. By way of example, one will need to show that God the Son himself, not just his divine nature, can have the property of omnipotence, even though he is omnipotent only because that property belongs to his divine nature. Also, one would need to show that God the Son himself, can have the property of lacking strength, even though he has that property only because it is a part of his human nature. Though this description of the requisite demonstration has the appearance of an impossibility, Eleonore Stump argues that with the notion of a “borrowed property” ─ a concept she finds implicit in Thomas Aquinas’s (1225-1274) work on the incarnation (Stump, 2002, 205-206) ─ it is possible to steer clear of contradiction and stay within the confines of Chalcedon.

For an explicit account of borrowed property, Eleonore Stump draws on the work of Lynne Rudder Baker:

Borrowing walks a fine line. On the one hand, if x borrows H from y, then x really has H-piggyback, so to speak . . . If I cut my hand, then I really bleed . . . I borrow the property of bleeding from my body, but I really bleed. But the fact that I am bleeding is none other than the fact that I am constituted by a body that is bleeding. So, not only does x really have H by borrowing it, but also ─ and this is the other hand ─ if x borrows H from y, there are not two independent instances of H: if x borrows H, then x’s having H is entirely a matter of having constitution elations to something that has H non-derivatively. [quoted in (Stump 2002), p. 205]

Stump provides an illustration of borrowed properties. She notes that Mark Twain’s Letters From the Earth is both comic and serious; as a biting critique of Christianity it is serious and as a satire it is comic. The work as a whole borrows the property of seriousness from its overall aim, while borrowing its comic property from Twain’s sarcasm and humor. So, Letters From the Earth is serious, with respect to its attack on Christianity, and comic, with respect to Twain’s use of humor. In a like manner, God the Son is omniscient with respect to his divine nature, and limited in knowledge with respect to his human nature. Just as the apparently incompatible properties, being comic and being serious, can be predicated of Letters From the Earth as a whole, when they are taken to be borrowed properties, so property pairs like unlimited knowledge and limited knowledge can be predicated of the person, God the Son, when they are understood as borrowed properties. The person, God the Son, borrows the property of omniscience from his divine nature and the property of limited knowledge from his human nature. As such, God the Son as (qua) divine is omniscient and as (qua) human is limited in knowledge.

4. Conclusion

The claim that God the Son Incarnate is truly human and truly divine appears to run afoul of the law of non-contradiction, which states that nothing can both be and not be at the same time and in the same respect. Four approaches to this incompatibility problem stand out: giving up the law of non-contradiction; adopting a relative account of identity; reconsidering the properties required for being truly human and/or divine; showing that God Incarnate does not possess any property and its complement in the same respect. Versions of the third and fourth approaches include Thomas V. Morris’s two-minds view, Richard Swinburne’s divided-mind account, Ronald J. Feenstra’s kenotic view, Marilyn Adams’ qualified-property perspective, and Eleonore Stump’s borrowed-property account. Significantly, all of these philosophers argue that their positions are compatible with the Chalcedonian Creed.

5. References and Further Reading

Adams, Marilyn McCord. 2006. Christ and Horrors. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Cross, Richard. 2002. The Metaphysics of God Incarnate. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Davis, Stephen T. 2006. Christian Philosophical Theology. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Evans, C. Stephen. 2002. “The Self-Emptying of Love: Some Thoughts on Kenotic Christology” in Davis, Stephen T.; Kendall, Daniel, SJ; O’Collins, Gerald, S.J. eds. The Incarnation. Oxford: Oxford University Press. pp. 246-272.
Evans, C. Stephen. 2006a. “Introduction” in C. Stephen Evans ed. Exploring Kenotic Christology: The Self-Emptying of God. Oxford: Oxford University Press. pp. 1-24.
Evans, C. Stephen. 2006b. “Kenotic Christology and the Nature of God” in C. Stephen Evans ed. Exploring Kenotic Christology: The Self-Emptying of God. Oxford: Oxford University Press. pp. 190-217.
Feenstra, Ronald J. 1989. “Reconsidering Kenotic Christology” in Feenstra, Ronald J. and Plantinga, Cornelius, Jr. eds. Trinity Incarnation and Atonement. Notre Dame, IN: University of Notre Dame Press.
Feenstra, Ronald J. 2006 “A Kenotic Christological Method for Understanding the Divine Attributes” in C. Stephen Evans ed. Exploring Kenotic Christology: The Self-Emptying of God. Oxford: Oxford University Press. pp. 139-164.
Hick, John. 1993. The Metaphor of God Incarnate. Louisville, KY: Westminster Press.
Leftow, Brian. 1992. “A Timeless God Incarnate ” in eds. Davis, Stephen T.; Kendall, Daniel, SJ; O’Collins, Gerald, S.J. eds. The Incarnation. Oxford: Oxford University Press. pp. 273-299.
Lewis, C.S. 1961. A Grief Observed. New York: Bantam Books.
Morris, Thomas V. 1986. The Logic of God Incarnate. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press.
Morris, Thomas V. 1991. Our Idea of God. Notre Dame, IN: University of Notre Dame Press.
Olson, Roger E. 1999. The Story of Christian Theology. Downers Grove, IL: InterVarsity Press.
Plantinga, Alvin. 1976. The Nature of Necessity. Oxford, Oxford University Press.
Plantinga, Alvin. 1984. “Advice to Christian Philosophers” in Faith and Philosophy, Vol. 1, Number 3. pp. 253-271.
Stump, Eleonore. 2002. “Aquinas’ Metaphysics of Incarnation” in eds. Davis, Stephen T.; Kendall, Daniel, SJ; O’Collins, Gerald, S.J. eds. The Incarnation. Oxford: Oxford University Press. pp. 197-220.
Swinburne, Richard. 1989. “Could God Become Man?” in ed. Godfrey Vesey, The Philosophy in Christianity. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press. pp.53-70.
Swinburne, Richard. 1994. The Christian God. Oxford: Clarendon Press.

Author information

David Werther
Email: dwerther@dcs.wisc.edu
University of Wisconsin, Madison
U. s. A.

Dai Zhen (Tai Chen, 1724—1777)

Table of Contents

1. Life and Works

2. Moral Agency

a. Dai’s Critique of the Neo-Confucian Account

b. Sympathy as a Form of Moral Deliberation

3. Human Nature and Moral Cultivation

4. Metaphysics and Metaethics

5. Influence

6. References and Further Reading

Author Information

Benedict de Spinoza: Epistemology

Table of Contents

1. The Role of Knowledge in Spinoza’s Philosophy

1a. Why Search for Knowledge?

1b. Knowledge in the Ethics

2. Spinoza’s Method for Epistemology

2a. The Geometric Method

2b. The Sub Specie Model, or Perspectivism

3. The First Kind of Knowledge

3a. Imagination

3b. Prejudice and Superstition

3c. Miracles, Prophecy, and Revelation

4. The Second Kind of Knowledge

4a. Intellection

4b. Common Notions

4c. Reason

5. The Third Kind of Knowledge

5a. Intuition

5b. Love and Blessedness

6. References and Further Reading

Author Information

Louise-Françoise de la Baume Le Blanc, marquise de La Vallière (1644—1710)

Table of Contents

1. Biography

2. Works

3. Moral Philosophy

3a. Virtue Theory

3b. Nature and Grace

3c. Theory of Passions

4. Reception and Interpretation

5. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

b. Secondary Sources

Author Information

Anne-Thérèse Marguenat de Courcelles, marquise de Lambert (1647—1733)

Table of Contents

1. Biography

2. Works

3. Philosophical Themes

a. Virtue Theory

b. Gender and Dignity

c. Ethics of Love

d. Social Criticism

e. Religious Philosophy

f. Aesthetics

g. Cartesianism

4. Reception and Interpretation

5. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

b. Secondary Sources

Author Information

Françoise d’Aubigné, marquise de Maintenon (1635—1719)

Table of Contents

1. Biography

2. Works

3. Philosophical Themes

a. Philosophy of Education

b. Virtue Theory

c. Virtue and Gender

d. Virtue and Class

4. Reception and Interpretation

5. References and Further Reading

Author information

Incarnation

Table of Contents

1. The Historical Framework

2. The Incompatibility Problem

3. Responses to the Incompatibility Problem

a. Rejecting the Law of Non-contradiction