Monthly Archives: April 2010

Tibetan Philosophy

The term “Tibet” refers to a geographic area around the Himalayan mountains and the culture which originated there.  Tibetan thought is a living tradition of rigorous argumentation, psychological insights, and philosophically relevant ideas concerning metaphysics, epistemology, ethics, and moral psychology.  It has a rigorous and formal system of philosophical debate and a wealth of meditative traditions, both of which provide insights for the nature of reality, the self, and truth.

Though it is strongly influenced by earlier Indian Buddhist philosophy, it offers a range of perspectives on these issues and presents many insights and practices of its own.  This article will provide an overview of topics that have been influential in Tibetan thought and attempt to emphasize topics that are indigenously Tibetan or have been significantly developed by Tibetan thinkers.  It is important to keep in mind that Tibetan intellectual culture often treats innovation differently than that of the West.  When a thinker comes up with a new distinction, argument, or practice it is likely to be attributed to an older, often Indian, source for various reasons including (but by no means limited to) modesty, authority, loyalty, or admiration.

Though this article avoids assuming a background knowledge of Buddhism, an understanding of the basic ideas and worldview of Buddhism, in particular Mahāyāna Buddhism, is essential for understanding Tibetan philosophy.

The italicized parenthetical terms are Tibetan unless otherwise noted and they are transliterated using the Wylie system.  They are not meant to be essential for understanding the ideas of the article and are provided to avoid the confusion caused by different writers using different English glosses.

 

Table of Contents

  1. Introduction
    1. The Tibetan cultural sphere
      1. Language and Geography
      2. Religions
    2. Philosophy
      1. Religion and Philosophy
      2. Tibetan Debate
  2. Metaphysics and Epistemology
    1. Mādhyamaka and Yogācāra
    2. The Doctrine of the Two Truths
    3. Contemplative Practices
  3. Ethics and Moral Psychology
    1. Mahāyāna Buddhist Ethics
      1. The Bodhisattva Ideal
      2. Mismatched Categories
    2. Tibetan Emphases and Innovations
      1. Elegant Sayings
      2. The Stages of the Path
      3. Mind Training
  4. References and Further Reading

 

1. Introduction

a. The Tibetan Cultural Sphere

i. Language and Geography

The term “Tibetan” refers to a cultural sphere that includes not only the present day Tibetan Autonomous Region, but also parts of Sichuan, Yunnan, Gansu, and Qinghai provinces of the People’s Republic of China as well as areas of Nepal, Bhutan, and northern India.  Though the spoken language of Tibetan in these areas is quite diverse (and often mutually unintelligible), they share a common written heritage of literature, poetry, song, and philosophical texts.  However, Tibetan philosophy is very much a living tradition with a variety of philosophical views and topical emphases.

ii. Religions

Buddhism has had a profound influence on Tibetan thought and culture.  Buddhism began to gain influence in Tibet after it became favored by king Songtsän Gampo around 641 CE.  However, there is also an indigenous Tibetan religion known as Bön (bon). Despite a somewhat competitive history, Bön and Buddhism have influenced each other greatly, making it difficult to draw a clear distinction between the two.

Today there are four main sects of Tibetan Buddhism.  The difference between sects is not always purely philosophical but often involves which practices, lineage masters, and texts they emphasize and also which translations they use.  The four major sects are:

  1. Nyingma (rnying ma) “Ancient”
  2. Sakya (sa skya) “White Earth”
  3. Kagyu (bka’ brgyud) “Oral Transmission”
  4. Gelug (dge lugs) “Way of Virtue”

The Gelug, the sect of the Dalai Lamas, came to hold the majority of the political power from the seventeenth century onward.  Since the late nineteenth century a non-sectarian movement (ris med) encouraged by the current Dalai Lama has become popular and fostered a more open approach between sects and a mixing of practices.

The texts of Tibetan Buddhist Canon are divided into two sections.  The “Translated Words” or the Kangyur (bka’ ‘gyur), which are texts that are said to be the teaching of the Buddha and the “Translated Teachings” or the Tengyur (bstan ‘gyur), which are treatises and commentaries written by Indian and Tibetan authors.

b. Philosophy

i. Religion and Philosophy

Unlike Western Philosophy since the Enlightenment, there is no rigid separation between religion and philosophy in Tibetan thought.  This does not mean that Tibetan philosophy is essentially non-rational or superstitious in nature and should not preclude philosophical interest; not anymore than references to Apollo in Plato or God in Descartes prevents philosophers from finding interesting philosophical theses in their works.  However, this lack of separation between the religious and philosophical does mean that a modern reader must keep in mind that Tibetan thinkers are likely to have aims and motives outside those usually found in Western philosophy.

Being overwhelmingly Buddhist in nature, Tibetan philosophy has a soteriological aim; one engages in philosophical investigation not only to gain an understanding of the world, but so that such an understanding can aid in eliminating suffering. For Buddhists, all human suffering arises from misunderstanding the nature of the world; through study and philosophical reflection one can come to have a better grasp of the nature of reality —particularly of suffering and its causes.  When one understands this, one can avoid much suffering by beginning to act and cultivate dispositions that are in accord with reality.  Modern philosophical theorizing in the West is commonly thought to aim at discovering the nature of reality or of the best way to live.  However, such theorizing does not often include the aim of integrating such a view of reality into everyday actions or cultivating one’s own dispositions so as to actually live in the best way possible.  For Tibetans and the Buddhist tradition more generally, since the goal of philosophical investigation is to produce a practical result, one deals not only with questions like “What is the best way to act?” but also “How can I come to act that way?”

ii. Tibetan Debate

The distinctive form of Tibetan debate (rtsod pa) plays an important part of philosophical investigations in Tibetan intellectual communities.  It is central in the Gelug sect, in particular those earning their kenpo (mkhan po) degrees, though it is also practiced in other sects to varying degrees.  The practice involves a seated defender (dam bca’ ba) and a standing challenger (rigs lam pa).  The roles are quite different; the defender must assert a thesis and attempts to defend its truth.  The challenger, however, asks questions in an attempt to get the defender to accept statements that are contradictory (for example, both “all colors are white” and “there is a color that is red”) or absurd (for example, “the color of a white religious conch shell is red”).  The challenger is not held responsible for the truth content of the questions; like someone raising an objection at a lecture, the challenger does not have to assert any thesis, but only aims to show that the defender is mistaken.

The debate begins with the challenger invoking Mañjuśrī, the bodhisattva of wisdom.  This invocation is variously interpreted, but can be seen most generally as a reminder to the debaters that they are aiming at wisdom, at finding out the truth about the subject.  The challenger then sets the topic of debate by asking a question to which the defender replies and reveals his thesis. The challenger may ask questions to clarify the defender’s thesis or establish common assumptions or simply begin the debate.  During the debate, the challenger raises questions of a particular form; a complete question is one that contains a subject, predicate, and a reason.  For example, the question “(Do you agree that) the subject, Socrates, is mortal because of being a man (?)” ascribes a predicate (being mortal) to the subject (Socrates) in virtue of a reason (being a man).  When an element is omitted or ambiguous, the defender is allowed to clarify, but upon receiving a complete question, the defender has three possible replies:

  1. “I accept” (’dod)
  2. “The reason is not established” (rtags ma grub)
  3. “It does not pervade” (ma khyab)

If the defender thinks that the proposed relationship between the subject, predicate, and reason holds, then she responds with “I accept.”  When the subject does not correspond to the reason, the defender asserts that the reason is not established. For example, “Socrates is mortal because of being an elephant” would warrant this reply because the reason, being an elephant, does not apply to the subject, Socrates.  The denial of pervasion, a Tibetan innovation that is not found in earlier Indian Buddhist debate system of Dharmakīrti, claims that the reason does not entail the predicate.  There are two kinds of failures of pervasion — one of uncertainty (ma nges pa) and one of contradiction or exclusion (’gal pa).  “Socrates is a philosopher because of being a man” is uncertain because some but not all men are philosophers; the reason, being a man, does not entail the predicate, being a philosopher. “Socrates is a reptile because of being a man” is contradictory because the terms “men” and “reptile” are exclusive; there are no men that are reptiles.

2. Metaphysics and Epistemology

a. Mādhyamaka and Yogācāra

Metaphysics and epistemology in Tibet are deeply rooted in Indian Mahāyāna Buddhist philosophy.  A focal question concerns what, if anything, has an intrinsic, unchanging essence or nature (Sanskrit: svabhāva)?  One may ask about a chair or one’s self if there is some intrinsic chair-ness or self-ness to be found. The two major schools that came to Tibet from Indian Mahāyāna Buddhism, Yogācāra (the “Mind Only” school) and Mādhyamaka (the “Middle Way” school) provide somewhat different answers to this.

The Yogācāra school, associated with Vasubandhu and his half-brother Asaṅga, replies that awareness or consciousness is the only thing with an intrinsic essence.  The general idea is that while what we perceive as reality might not have an intrinsic nature, the awareness that we have of the flow of such perceptions does have such a nature.  This school is sometimes compared with German Idealism in the West.

The Mādhyamaka school, founded by Nāgārjuna, denies that anything has an unchanging essence; this is known as the Doctrine of Emptiness (Sanskrit: śūnyatā).  To say that all phenomena are empty is to say that they are empty of a stable and unconditioned essence — tables have no intrinsic table-ness and selves have no intrinsic self-ness. This may sound extreme, but Mādhyamaka sees itself as being a middle way between the extremes of positing an entity with an eternal essence and the nihilistic denial of any existence at all (to say a chair lacks an unchanging essence is not to say that it does not exist at all).  Though the Mādhyamaka view, championed by the Gelug sect, is often seen in Tibet as the higher teaching, both Yogācāra and Mādhyamaka ideas are present.

Within the Mādhyamaka school there is a distinction over the proper method of discourse with non-Mādhyamaka philosophers, specifically whether or not it is appropriate to make positive assertions in debate. The Svātantrika view, associated with Bhāvaviveka, permits the use of assertions and independent syllogisms in debate. However, the Prāsaṅgika view, attributed to Chandrakīrti and Buddhapālita, permits only the use of logical consequences, a kind of negative method of reductio ad absurdum to establish the Mādhyamaka view in debate.  Anything else, they contend, would give the impression that they accept the unconditioned essence of any of the topics under debate.  This method has been compared with that of Wittgenstein (at least the Wittgenstein of the Tractatus Logico-Philosophicus) and the Skeptics of ancient Greece.

It is important to note that this distinction is an indigenous Tibetan one; there is no evidence of either of the terms being used by Indian Mādhyamaka philosophers. The Sanskrit terms Prāsaṅgika and Svātantrika are inventions of Western scholars to translate the Tibetan terms rang rgyud pa (the Autonomists or Svātantrika) and thal ’gyur pa (the Consequentialists or Prāsaṅgika).  Through the influence of the immensely important Gelug thinker Tsongkhapa, the Prāsaṅgika became the more influential view in Tibet. A clear and accessible entry point to these issues can be found in Jamgön Mipham’s Introduction to the Middle Way.

b. The Doctrine of the Two Truths

A seminal concept in Mādhyamaka thought, and in Mahāyāna Buddhism generally, is the idea that there are two truths: a conventional or nominal truth (Sanskrit: saṃvṛti-satya) and an ultimate truth (Sanskrit: paramārtha-satya).  The idea is similar to Berkeley’s dictum that we think with the learned, but speak with the vulgar; we can accept certain conventions without thinking them to be ultimately real.  The notion can be understood epistemically or metaphysically; the term rendered here as “truth” (Sanskrit: satya, Tibetan: bden pa) can mean “true” in the sense of a true proposition but also “real” in the sense of something actually existing in the way that it appears. Suppose one were to stumble upon a friend watching a Felix the Cat cartoon ask him what is happening. The friend is likely to reply with something like, “Felix just got hit on the head with a hammer and he’s mad.” The reply is conventionally true; the question was asked from within a system of conventions — one that assumes there are entities called characters that can perform actions and feel emotions — and the reply is true within those conventions. When pressed, both may well admit that the ultimate truth is quite different; in fact there is no Felix, simply a series of lines organized in a certain way so as to create drawings that bear a resemblance to a cat, which, when shown in rapid succession create the visual illusion of actions, events, and emotions. This is the ultimate truth about what is really happening, but to reply in this way would be both impolite and pragmatically unhelpful. The view has some affinities with fictionalism in Western philosophy in that both acknowledge some value in claims that are metaphysically ungrounded.

For the Mādhyamaka philosopher, talk of physical objects, persons, causes, and all other phenomena is true only in the conventional sense. One issue of debate in Tibet has been the relationship between the Two Truths. A radical view advocated in the fourteenth century by Dolpopa claims that the Two Truths are completely separate, advocating a doctrine called Emptiness of Other (gzhan stong) — the ideal that emptiness itself has a stable and unchanging nature.  The prevailing view, advocated by Tsongkhapa and the Gelug tradition, proposes a deep unity between the two truths. This view holds the distinction between the conventional and ultimate reality to be itself merely conventional, a doctrine called Emptiness of Self (rang stong). On this view, the property of lacking an essential nature is nothing more than a conventional designation (for more on this see Kapstein 2001 pp.221ff). The idea that emptiness itself is not an ultimately real property — the emptiness of emptiness — is taken to be paradoxical to varying degrees (see Garfield 1995 pp. 319-321 and Hayes 1994) and it is said to be one of the most difficult and subtle points in Mādhyamaka philosophy.

The Two Truths are especially important when one keeps in mind the soteriological aim of Buddhist philosophy; it allows a place for teachings that are not strictly speaking true, but benefit the student. The language used in Tibetan to translate “conventional truth” reflects this; the most common terms, both translated into English as “conventional” are tanyé (tha snyad) and kundzob (kun rdzob). The former means simply a mental label for something, a conventional sign for communications, while the latter, kundzob, means something that obscures, hides, or fakes. The distinction suggests two sorts of conventional truth; those that obscure the ultimate truth and those that do not. This finds support in common sense as some false speech is used to obscure reality, as in that of political spinsters, while other false speech is used to illuminate a truth about reality, such as telling a fictional story to teach a truth about human psychology. This distinction is explained in greater detail at Garfield (2002) pp.60ff, where he notes that emptiness itself is conventional in the illuminating tanyé sense, but not in the concealing kundzob sense.

c. Contemplative Practices

There are also more meditative practices that allow the meditator to experience the emptiness of phenomena in a more direct way. One tradition, associated with the Kagyu sect and known in Sanskrit as Mahāmudrā (Tibetan: phyag rgya chen po) meaning “The Great Seal”). Another tradition known as Dzogchen (rdzogs chen) or “The Great Perfection” has its roots in the Bön and Nyingma traditions.  These practices tend to emphasize first-hand experience and the relationship with a qualified teacher.

The core of these practices involves close observation of the mind at rest and during the arising and passing of thoughts and emotions. Through this kind of meditation one comes to see one’s own true nature (ngo rang) and directly experience emptiness. These mediations are often described with language suggesting spontaneity, immediacy, and ineffability — a non-conceptual and non-dualistic awareness of reality, which is taken to be in some sense perfect as it is. To many, these features evoke affinities with mysticism that put it outside the purview of modern Analytic philosophy, though epistemological issues like introspection, phenomenology, and the limits of language are relevant.

3. Ethics and Moral Psychology

The ethics of Tibetan philosophy is inextricably linked to Buddhist ethics, in particular the ideas of Mahāyāna Buddhism.  The Mahāyāna Buddhist tradition is far too varied and vast to be adequately covered here, so what follows is a small sampling of some of the issues that have received a good deal of attention in Tibetan thought and some of the indigenous Tibetan innovations.

a. Mahāyāna Buddhist Ethics

i. The Bodhisattva Ideal

A concept central to the distinction between Mahāyāna (“The Greater Vehicle”) and the earlier Therevāda (“The School of the Elders”) Buddhism is that of the Bodhisattva. The term “bodhisattva” (literally “enlightenment-being”) in the older Pāli literature is used to describe the Buddha before he became enlightened. There is a collection of stories of the Buddha’s previous lives, known as the Jātaka Tales, which describe how the Buddha of our time behaved in his previous lives as an animal, human, or other creature. The tales teach a moral by describing the selfless and virtuous actions of the Buddha-to-be and in these tales he is called a bodhisattva. The ideal, however, in Therevāda Buddhism is one who is awakened and escaped suffering — a Buddha.

In Mahāyāna Buddhism the Bodhisattva began to take on a more central role as a spiritual and ethical ideal. Bodhisattvas, rather than becoming enlightened and escaping the sufferings of this world, choose to forgo their own enlightenment and remain in this world in order to relieve the suffering of others. The idea is rooted in earlier Indian thought, such as the classic, Way of the Bodhisattva (Sanskrit: Bodhicaryāvatāra) by Śāntideva, the emphasis on the Bodhisattva figure and the ideal of selfless compassion are central to ethics in Tibet as well. Scores of texts composed in Tibetan praise the Bodhisattva and their motives (Sanskrit: bodhicitta) from Thogmé Zangpo’s Thirty-Seven Practices of Bodhisattvas (Tibetan: rgyal sras lag len so bdun ma) to the more recent Vast as the Heavens, Deep as the Sky (Tibetan: byang chub sems kyi bstod pa rin chen sgron ma) by Khunu Rinpoche.

ii. Mismatched Categories

Modern scholars disagree about the most accurate way to view Buddhist ethics in terms of the standard Western ethical categories. Buddhist ethics seems to have affinities with all of the major ethical theories in the West. Its emphasis on the elimination of suffering is similar to Utilitarian theories like that of Jeremy Bentham, its emphasis on a universal outlook is similar to the Kantian claims about the categorical imperative, and its Bodhisattva seems similar to the sort of ideal agents imagined in Virtue Ethics.

Naturally, there are problems with each interpretation.  It is not clear that the Utilitarian framework can account for the intrinsic value given to certain motivations and the intrinsic value given to skillful actions; for example, one might think that skillful actions (Sanskrit: kuśala) lead to the elimination of suffering because they are right, not vice versa. It is also not clear that a Kantian framework can accommodate the central role of compassion and sympathy and given the importance of the consequences of actions given in Buddhist ethics, the Kantian framework seems ill-fitting.

The view championed by Damien Keown is a characterization of Buddhist ethics in terms of Aristotelian virtue ethics. For Aristotle, one develops certain character traits so that one may achieve flourishing (Greek: eudaimonia).  Similarly, argues Keown, the bodhisattva develops certain traits with the goal of achieving freedom from suffering (Sanskrit: nirvana). The argument claims that flourishing and freedom both function as a goal for which the development of good traits is cultivated. But many scholars, famously Peter Harvey, claim that Buddhist ethics cannot be placed entirely in any single Western category.  Instead, they see Buddhist ethics as being best understood as having similarities with each, though not exclusively falling into any particular one.

b. Tibetan Emphases and Innovations

i. Elegant Sayings

A popular genre of ethical advice in Tibet is that of Legshé (legs bshad) or “Elegant Sayings.” These are related to the Indian subhāṣita format and are unusually secular in content for Tibetan literature. They are in verse form, usually with four line stanzas with seven syllables per line. Commonly studied in schools and memorized, these are very popular among Tibetans and often familiar to non-scholars.

The most popular of these texts, The Elegant Sayings of Sakya Paṇḍita (sa skya legs bshad) was composed by Sakya Paṇḍita, an important figure in the Sakya sect around the Thirteenth century. The content often concerns the traits and conduct of wise (mkhas pa), noble (ya rabs) and foolish (blun po) people along with other advice regarding common human problems and tendencies. The advice is often juxtaposed with a metaphor or similar case from everyday life.  For example, regarding determining who is wise, Sakya Paṇḍita writes:

Without questioning a wise person,

One cannot measure their depth.

Without striking a drum with a stick,

One cannot distinguish it from other drums.

Important topics include the best attitude towards achievement and failure, praise and blame, wealth, anger, and work (among others). Sakya Paṇḍita’s text inspired many similar texts, popularly Virtuous Good Advice (dge ldan legs bshad) by Panchan Sonam Drakpa, which is quite similar to Sakya Paṇḍita’s text and A Treatise on Water and Wood (chu shing bstan bcos) by Gung Thang Tenpé Dronmé, which uses only forest and water imagery. A more detailed introduction to Legshé literature and a translation of Sakya Paṇḍita’s text can be found in John Davenport’s Ordinary Wisdom.

ii. The Stages of the Path

A conceptual frame that became important in Tibet is the idea of stages on the path to enlightenment (lam rim). Its roots are in the Indian Buddhist idea of Bodhisattva Stages (Sanskrit: bodhisattva-bhumi) though the notion took hold through the Bengali monk Atiśa, who was invited to Tibet to clarify the teachings early in the eleventh century. In his Lamp for the Path to Enlightenment (byang chub lam gyi sgron ma), Atiśa distinguishes three kinds of persons/abilities (skyes bu gsum):

  1. Person of Small Ability (skyes bu chung ba)
  2. Person of Intermediate Ability (skyes bu ’bring ba)
  3. Person of Great Ability (skyes bu chen po)

Those of Small Ability can seek only worldly pleasures and are concerned with their own happiness and their future well-being. Those of Intermediate Ability are able to reject worldly pleasures, but seek to end only their own suffering.  Those of Great Ability take on suffering in order to end the suffering of others.  This division can be understood as applying to the particular situation in Tibet in which mass monasticism and more esoteric forms of Buddhism could both be found. The teaching of the three kinds of abilities can be understood as a schema for determining whether or not a monk is ready for certain higher teachings and practices. The threefold division can also be understood in a wider sense, applying to people in general and how to gauge their abilities.

Aside from the obvious emphasis on altruism, the doctrine exemplifies what Harvey (2000 p.51) terms gradualism. For many ethical systems in the West, normative prescriptions apply to everyone (or perhaps everyone who can grasp them regardless of ethical development). In many forms of Buddhist ethics, though some prescriptions like refraining from taking life apply to everyone, others only apply to those with a certain depth of moral or spiritual understanding. Harvey notes that while lay practitioners usually follow five precepts, an ordained monk is subject to two hundred or more. Similarly, different teachings, practices, and requirements are suitable for the three kinds of abilities. Those of Small Ability might benefit most from reflecting on the impermanence of worldly pleasures and the inevitability of death, while the kind of altruism and patience that those of higher stages develop is out of their reach and could prove detrimental to demand of them. Atiśa notes that just as birds with undeveloped wings cannot fly, people with undeveloped understanding cannot help others in certain ways. The implication seems to be that just as we cannot demand of baby birds that they fly, we can encourage them to act in ways that nurtures the development of their wings.

iii. Mind Training

An area developed extensively in Tibet is that of Lojong (blo sbyong) or Mind Training. Recall that because of the soteriological aspect of Tibetan ethics, the aim is not solely to give an account for what the right actions and attitudes are, but to come to manifest those attitudes and actually act in that way. Lojong is a type of meditative practice that aims at helping the practitioner to generate compassion and lessen attachment to external factors like praise and popular opinion.

One kind of Lojong, often associated with Śāntideva, is the practice of Exchanging Self and Other (bdag gzhan mnyam brje). In this practice the meditator imagines himself to be another person; often a sequence of people who are beneath, equal to, and then superior to the practitioner in some respect.  By doing this, the practitioner can come to realize that the other person is the same as them in that they wish to be happy and avoid suffering. After some practice, it becomes easier to overcome obstacles (both petty and serious) to treating others in a compassionate way.

Another kind of Lojong practice, often attributed to Atiśa but popularized by Chekawa Yeshe Dorje, is that of Giving and Taking (gtong len). In this practice one imagines oneself taking in the suffering of others, and gives to them happiness in return. This often takes the form of visualizing that with each breath, one inhales the suffering of others as thick black smoke and exhales happiness to them in the form of white light.

A general feature of Lojong is the development of an ability to take negative circumstances, like being surrounded by suffering or anger, and transform it into positive attitudes and actions. Two foundational texts in this regard are Eight Verses for Training the Mind (blo sbyong tshig brgyad ma) by Geshé Langri Tangpa and The Seven-Point Mind Training (blo sbyong don bdun ma) by Chekawa Yeshé Dorjé.

4. References and Further Reading

  • Clayton, Barbra. 2006. Moral Theory in Śāntideva’s Śikṣāsamuccaya. New York: Routledge.
    • Though primarily a discussion of Śāntideva’s lesser-known work, it has a good overview of his life and works as an informed discussion of how to consider Buddhist ethics in Western categories.
  • Dreyfus, Georges J. B. 2003. The Sound of Two Hands Clapping: The Education of a Tibetan Buddhist Monk. Berkeley: University of California Press.
    • This first-hand account of Tibetan monastic life offers a realistic picture of the actual practices as well as excellent information on Tibetan debate.
  • Garfield, Jay. 2002. Empty Words. New York: Oxford University Press.
    • An insightful collection of essays on a variety of topics in Buddhist Philosophy which focuses on Tibetan Buddhism and Analytic Philosophy.
  • Garfield, Jay. trans. 1995. The Fundamental Wisdom of the Middle Way: Nāgārjuna’s Mūlamadhyamakakārikā. New York: Oxford University Press.
    • A translation from the Tibetan text of Nāgārjuna’s most famous philosophical work.  Garfield also provides very clear and philosophically informed commentary.
  • Harvey, Peter. 2000. An Introduction to Buddhist Ethics. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
    • A very clear introduction to Buddhist ethics with an emphasis on normative questions.
  • Hayes, Richard. 1994. “Nāgārjuna’s Appeal” in The Journal of Indian Philosophy Vol. 22, pp.299-378.
    • A classic paper that argues that Nāgārjuna’s arguments essentially rely on the fallacy of equivocation over the term Svabhāva.
  • Kapstein, Matthew. 2001. Reasons Traces. Boston: Wisdom Publications.
    • A philosophically informed discussion of personal identity, metaphysics, and epistemology in Indian and Tibetan Buddhism.
  • Keown, Damien. 1992. The Nature of Buddhist Ethics. New York: St. Martin’s Press.
    • A very interesting philosophical discussion of Buddhist ethics, offering an interpretation of Buddhist ethics that emphasizes the similarity to Aristotelian virtue ethics.
  • Khunu Rinpoche. Gareth Sparham, trans. 1999. Vast as the Heavens Deep as the Sea. Boston: Wisdom Publications.
    • A recent text in verse form praising bodhicitta, the aspiration for enlightenment.
  • Mipham, Jamgön and Chandrakirti. Padmakara Translation Group trans. 2002. Introduction to the Middle Way. Boston: Shambhala Press.
    • As a translation of Chandrakīrti’s Madhyamakāvatāra with commentary by Mipham Jamgön, it is an important primary text.  Its introduction provides a very clear and understandable way into Mādhyamaka philosophy.
  • Patrul Rinpoche. 1998. Words of My Perfect Teacher. Boston: Shambhala Press.
    • A very popular practical guide and explanation of the Tibetan Buddhist spiritual path.
  • Perdue, Daniel. 1992. Debate in Tibetan Buddhism. Ithaca: Snow Lion Press.
    • An extensive translation and explanation of an introductory Tibetan debate manual.
  • Rossi, Donatella. 1999. The Philosophical View of the Great Perfection in the Tibetan Bon Religion. Ithaca: Snow Lion Press.
    • An overview of Dzog Chen in the Bön and Nyingma traditions; includes translations along with the original Tibetan.
  • Sakya Pandita. John Davenport trans. 2000. Ordinary Wisdom. Boston: Wisdom Publications.
    • A translation and explanation of the most famous of the Legs Bshad texts.
  • Sonam Rinchen and Ruth Sonam. 1997. The Thirty-Seven Practices of Bodhisattvas. Ithaca: Snow Lion Press.
  • Sonam Rinchen and Ruth Sonam. 1997. Atisha’s Lamp for the Path to Enlightenment. Ithaca: Snow Lion Press.
  • Sonam Rinchen and Ruth Sonam. 2001. Eight Verses for Training the Mind. Ithaca: Snow Lion Press.
    • These editions are translations by Ruth Sonam and explanations by Geche Sonam Rinchen.  They all include the original Tibetan and offer clear background for understanding the root texts.
  • Sparham, Gareth. 1993. Ocean of Eloquence. New York: SUNY Press.
    • A translation of Tsong Kha Pa’s commentary on the Yogācāra Doctrine of Mind.  An example of Yogācāra study and practice in Tibet.
  • Thupten Jinpa, ed. 2006. Mind Training: The Great Collection. Boston: Wisdom Publications.
    • An excellent collection of the Lojong or “Mind Training” literature with commentaries.
  • Thurman, Robert. 1991. The Central Philosophy of Tibet: A Study and Translation of Jey Tsong Khapa’s Essence of True Eloquence. Princeton: Princeton University Press.
    • A long introduction gives a detailed overview of Tibetan philosophy followed by a translation of an important text on Mādhyamaka by Tsong Kha Pa.
  • Wayman, Alex. 1991. Ethics of Tibet. New York: SUNY Press.
    • A translation and explanation of the Bodhisattva section of Tsong Kha Pa’s Lamrim Chenmo.  Offers an overview of the stages of the bodhisattva path.

 

 

Author Information

 

Nicolas Bommarito
Email:  npbommar@buffalo.edu
University at Buffalo
U. S. A.

 

Divine Immutability

Divine immutability, the claim that God is immutable, is a central part of traditional Christianity, though it has come under sustained attack in the last two hundred years.  This article first catalogues the historical precedent for and against this claim, then discusses different answers to the question, “What is it to be immutable?”   Two definitions of divine immutability receive careful attention.  The first is that for God to be immutable is for God to have a constant character and to be faithful in divine promises; this is a definition of “weak immutability.”  The second, “strong immutability,” is that for God to be immutable is for God to be wholly unchanging. After showing some implications of the definitions, the article focuses on strong immutability and provides some common arguments against the claim that God is immutable, understood in that way.  While most of the historical evidence discussed in this article is from Christian sources, the core discussion of what it is to be strongly immutable, and the arguments against it, are not particular to Christianity.

Table of Contents

  1. Some Historical Evidence for Divine Immutability
    1. Biblical Evidence for and against Divine Immutability
    2. Conciliar Evidence for Divine Immutability
    3. The Protestant Reformers and Divine Immutability
    4. Divine Immutability and Traditional Christianity
  2. What It Is To Be Immutable
    1. Immutability as Constancy of Character
    2. Strong Immutability—God Does Not Change in Any Way
  3. Objections to Strong Immutability
    1. God’s Knowledge of Temporally Indexed Truths, Omniscience and Immutability
    2. Immutability and Modal Collapse
    3. Responsiveness and an Immutable God
    4. Personhood and Immutability
    5. Immutability, Time, and Freedom
  4. Related Issues
    1. Divine Timelessness or Eternality
    2. Divine Impassibility
    3. The Incarnation
    4. Intrinsic/Extrinsic Properties
  5. References and Further Reading

1. Some Historical Evidence for Divine Immutability

Divine immutability is a central aspect of the traditional Christian doctrine of God, as this section will argue. For more detail on this point, see Dorner (1994) chapter 2 and Weinandy (1985).

a. Biblical Evidence for and against Divine Immutability

There are many biblical passages commonly cited as evidence either for or against the doctrine of divine immutability. This short section discusses just a few, with the aim of showing that the Bible is not explicitly clear one way or the other on the question of whether God is immutable. (See Gavrilyuk (2004), p 37-46, for a discussion of these passages and others.) Whichever view one takes on immutability, there are difficult passages for which one has to account.

In some places the Bible appears to speak in favor of divine mutability. For instance, consider these two passages:

Did Hezekiah king of Judah or anyone else in Judah put [Micah] to death? Did not Hezekiah fear the LORD and seek his favor? And did not the LORD relent, so that he did not bring the disaster he pronounced against them? (Jeremiah 26:19. This and all subsequent quotations from the Bible are taken from the New International Version).

In this first example we see the Lord relenting, not doing what he had said he would do.  That appears to be a case of changing from one course or plan of action to another.  Such change seems even clearer in the following case, where God, in response to a sin of David, both sends an angel to destroy Jerusalem, then, grieving the destruction, calls off the angel.

And God sent an angel to destroy Jerusalem. But as the angel was doing so, the LORD saw it and was grieved because of the calamity and said to the angel who was destroying the people, “Enough! Withdraw your hand” (1 Chronicles 21:15).

In this example, God puts a particular plan of action into effect, then, it appears, grieves his decision and reverses it.  God does it as a result of the calamity the angel was causing when destroying the people. God responds to his creation here, and relents.  Both of these texts, and others like them, seem to indicate that God changes, at least in changing his mind and commands. Other relevant biblical passages include, but are not limited to, Exodus 32:14 and Amos 7:1-3.

If all the evidence from the Bible were against immutability, one might think that the case against divine immutability, at least for the Christian and the Jew, would be closed.  However, the Bible also seems to teach that God does not change his mind.  For instance:

God is not a man, that he should lie, nor a son of man, that he should change his mind. Does he speak and then not act? Does he promise and not fulfill? (Numbers 23:19).

He who is the Glory of Israel does not lie or change his mind; for he is not a man, that he should change his mind (1 Samuel 15:29).

These two passages claim that God doesn’t change his mind and so are in tension with the previous two texts.  Beyond these two passages that claim that God does not change his mind, there are also passages where God is said not to change, for instance:

I the LORD do not change. So you, O descendants of Jacob, are not destroyed (Malachi 3:6).

Every good and perfect gift is from above, coming down from the Father of the heavenly lights, who does not change like shifting shadows (James 1:17).

Theologians and philosophers who wish to provide scriptural evidence for divine immutability have commonly cited these passages.

So the Biblical texts are either unclear as to whether God changes or not, or they are inconsistent.  If one wishes to maintain the consistency of scripture on the doctrine of God, one either needs to read the passages where God appears to change in light of the passages where it claims he does not, or vice versa.  But either way the Biblical evidence seems too weak to prove either divine immutability or its contrary.

b. Conciliar Evidence for Divine Immutability

While the biblical evidence seems to underdetermine whether divine immutability is true, the conciliar evidence favors the doctrine of divine immutability. While the later councils explicitly include immutability in their discussions of God’s nature, the earlier councils only discussed divine immutability in relation to the incarnation, the Christian teaching that the Second Person of the Trinity, the Son of God, became man.  This is because the incarnation seemed to require a change of some sort in God.  These early councils employed divine immutability to argue that there was no change in the Godhead when the Son became incarnate.

For instance, consider the conclusion to the creed of the first general council, Nicaea, in 325 (note that this is the end of the original creed, and not the more familiar Nicene-Constantinopolitan creed commonly employed in liturgies today):

And those who say “there once was when he was not”, and “before he was begotten he was not”, and that he came to be from things that were not, or from another hypostasis or substance, affirming that the Son of God is subject to change or alteration—these the catholic and apostolic church anathematizes (Tanner, 1990, p 5, emphasis  mine).

Here the council anathematizes those who claim that the Son of God is subject to change or alteration.  Some, particularly the Arians, were teaching that the Son was a creature and not the Creator.  This anathema is an attempt to rule out such a position by ruling out change in the Son, which only makes sense if God is changeless.  For, how would anathematizing the view that the Son changes rule out the Son’s being a creature unless being changing is incompatible with being God?  One should note, though, that even though the Arians taught that the Son was mutable, they didn’t deny the immutability of the Father, and in fact were attempting to safeguard the immutability of God in their teaching that the Son was a creature (see Gavrilyuk (2004) p 105-7, Weinandy (1985) p 5-20 for more on this).

Also, see the third letter of Cyril to Nestorius from the council of Ephesus, 431, which says, when speaking of Christ:

We do not say that his flesh was turned into the nature of the godhead or that the unspeakable Word of God was changed into the nature of the flesh. For he (the Word) is unalterable and absolutely unchangeable and remains always the same as the scriptures say (Tanner, 1990, p 51, the emphasis is mine.)

Here the council claims that the Word of God, the Second Person of the Trinity, is unalterable and absolutely unchangeable.  Notice, too, that the claim is made to defend against the unorthodox view that the twin natures of Christ mixed in the incarnation.  So whatever immutability comes to, it must come to something that rules out the admixture of natures.

Thirdly, see the Letter of Cyril to John of Antioch about Peace, again from the council of Ephesus:

…God the Word, who came down from above and from heaven, “emptied himself, taking the form of a slave”, and was called son of man, though all the while he remained what he was, that is God (for he is unchangeable and immutable by nature)… (Tanner,1990, p 72, the emphasis is mine).

Here the council claims that God is unchangeable and immutable by nature.  Whereas the first two passages cited attribute immutability to the Son, this passage attributes it more generally to God.  But even still, it would be an odd Trinitarian theology that claimed the Son to be immutable but the other Persons to be mutable. Also of note is the letter of Pope Leo to Flavian, bishop of Constantinople, about Eutyches, read at the council of Chalcedon where Pope Leo writes of “the unalterable God, whose will is indistinguishable from his goodness” (Tanner, 1990, p 79).

The closer to the present one comes in western conciliar documents, the more explicitly and repeatedly one finds affirmation of divine immutability. For instance, see the fourth council of Constantinople (869-870), the eighth ecumenical council, by western reckoning, where the Fathers claim in their creedal statement:

We confess, indeed, God to be one…ever existing without beginning, and eternal, ever the same and like to himself, and suffering no change or alteration… (Tanner, 1990, p 161).

Notice that here the object said to be without change or alteration is explicitly God.  The first two conciliar statements cited claim that the Son is immutable, and the third quotation appears to claim that God, and not just the Son, is immutable, but here the object is clearly God.  Also, the creed from the Fourth Lateran council, which met in 1215, begins, “We firmly believe and simply confess that there is only one true God, eternal and immeasurable, almighty, unchangeable, incomprehensible and ineffable…” (Tanner, 1990, p 230); the council of Basel-Ferrara-Florence-Rome, which met from 1431-1445, “deliver[ing]…the following true and necessary doctrine…firmly professes and preaches one true God, almighty, immutable and eternal…” (Tanner, 1990, p 570); the First Vatican council, which met from 1869-1870, “believes and acknowledges that there is one true and living God…he is one, singular, completely simple and unchangeable spiritual substance…” (Tanner, 1990, p 805)  Such texts show that the early church councils of undivided Christendom, as well as the later western councils of the Catholic Church, clearly teach that God is immutable.

c. The Protestant Reformers and Divine Immutability

It isn’t just early Christianity in general and Catholicism in particular that dogmatically affirms divine immutability.  One can find divine immutability in the confessions and canons of traditional Protestantism.  For instance, see the confession of faith from the French (or Gallican) Confession of 1559:

We believe and confess that there is but one God, who is one sole and simple essence, spiritual, eternal, invisible, immutable, infinite, incomprehensible, ineffable, omnipotent; who is all-wise all-good, all-just, and all-merciful (Schaff, 1877, p 359-360).

Also, see the Belgic Confession of 1561, Article 1:

We all believe with the heart, and confess with the mouth, that there is one only simple and spiritual Being, which we call God; and that he is eternal, incomprehensible invisible, immutable, infinite, almighty, perfectly wise, just, good, and the overflowing fountain of all good. (Schaff, 1877, p 383-384)

For a confessional Lutheran affirmation of divine immutability, see, for instance, “The Strong Declaration of The Formula of Concord,” XI.75, found in The Book of Concord:

And since our election to eternal life is founded not upon our godliness or virtue, but alone upon the merit of Christ and the gracious will of His Father, who cannot deny Himself, because He is unchangeable in will and essence…

In addition, see the first head, eleventh article of the canons of Dordt, from 1618-1619:

And as God himself is most wise, unchangeable, omniscient, and omnipotent, so the election made by him can neither be interrupted nor changed, recalled nor annulled; neither can the elect be cast away, nor their number diminished (Schaff, 1877, p 583).

And, finally, see the Westminster Confession of Faith from 1647:

There is but one only living and true God, who is infinite in being and perfection, ‘a most pure spirit, invisible, without body, parts, or passions, immutable, immense, eternal, incomprehensible, almighty, most wise, most holy… (Schaff, 1877, p 606).

These texts show that the dogmatic and confessional affirmations of divine immutability carry on into Protestantism.

d. Divine Immutability and Traditional Christianity

If one understands traditional Christianity either as the faith of the early, undivided Church or as the intersection of the great, historical confessional statements of Christendom, then one has strong reason to believe that traditional Christianity includes the claim that God is immutable.  Just because one has reason to affirm that God is immutable, however, does not give one reason to favor a particular definition of immutability.  The following section discusses the two leading rival theories of what it is for God to be immutable.

2. What It Is To Be Immutable

Even if it is clear that traditional Christianity includes the doctrine of divine immutability, what, precisely, that doctrine amounts to is not perspicuous.  There are many subtle and nuanced views of immutability—far too many to receive individual attention in this article.  This article focuses on the two most commonly discussed views of immutability.  One is that divine immutability merely guarantees that God’s character is unchanging, and that God will remain faithful to his promises and covenants.  This first view does not preclude other sorts of change in God.  Another, stronger, view of immutability is that the doctrine of divine immutability rules out all intrinsic change in God.  This latter understanding of immutability is the historically common view.

a. Immutability as Constancy of Character

Some thinkers see immutability as the claim that God’s character is constant.  For instance, see Richard Swinburne’s The Coherence of Theism, where he discusses both types of immutability under consideration in this section. Here he sides with the constancy of character view, which he describes as “[i]n the weaker way to say of a person that he is immutable is simply to say that he cannot change in character.” (Swinburne, 1993, p 219)  Isaak Dorner’s view is that God is ethically immutable but that divine vitality requires divine change. See Dorner (1994), especially the helpful introduction by Williams, p 19-23, and Dorner’s third essay, “The Reconstruction of the Immutability Doctrine.”  For discussions of Dorner, see Richards (2003) p 198-199 and Williams (1986). This view of immutability understands divine immutability to be the claim that God is constant in his character and virtue; that God is not fickle; and that God will remain true to his promises.

Notice that if immutability is understood in this sense, the Bible passages cited in section 1 may be easier to reconcile than on strong immutability.  The passages where God relents aren’t passages that prove that God is not constant in character.  It may well be God’s good character that causes him to relent.  Given the previous circumstances, God formed one set of intentions due to his constantly good character.  When the circumstances changed, God formed a different set of intentions, again due to his constantly good character.  What changes in these passages is not God’s good character. It is the circumstances God is in when he forms his intentions. Where the Bible teaches that God is unchanging, it means, in this understanding of immutability, that God’s character will not change.  It does not mean the stronger claim that God will not change at all.

One more point in favor of this understanding of immutability is that if it were true, other problems with divine immutability, problems discussed below in section 3, would no longer be problems.  For instance, there would be no problem of explaining how an unchanging God has knowledge of changing truths (e.g., like what time it is).  God’s knowledge could change, on this understanding of immutability, provided that such change in knowledge does not rule out constancy of character.

Another problem discussed in section 3 is that of the responsiveness of an immutable God.  Given weak immutability, divine immutability doesn’t necessitate divine unresponsiveness.  This is because God’s responding to prayers doesn’t require that his character change.  In fact, it could be exactly because his character does not change that he responds to prayers.  So responsiveness is not incompatible with this notion of immutability.  On the constancy of character understanding of immutability, not all change, and in particular, not change as a result of responding to prayer, is inconsistent with immutability.

Nevertheless, if this is the burden of divine immutability—that God’s character is constant—who would deny it (that is, what theist would deny it)?  Divine immutability is a modest thesis when understood as constancy of character.  But even if it is innocuous, and even if it has the above-mentioned positive features, it still has difficulties.  It still leaves a problem for biblical exegesis.  That’s because the first two passages discussed above in section 1 seem to show God changing his mind, whereas the second two seem to teach that God does not change his mind.  So while the fact that it provides some way to reconcile some of the biblical evidence is a point in favor of the constancy of character view, it still faces a difficulty in understanding the scriptures that seem to claim that God does not change his mind.

Moreover, divine immutability understood as only involving the constancy of character seems in tension with the use that the early teachings of the church at the first ecumenical councils made of the concept.  For instance, both quotations from the council of Ephesus claim that the Second Person of the Trinity did not change when assuming the human nature, and both point, as evidence, to the fact that he is unchangeable and immutable.  In fact, the second quotation from Ephesus has it that God is unchangeable and immutable by God’s very nature.  Immutability, however, would be no evidence for the claim that the Second Person of the Trinity didn’t change when assuming the human nature if all immutability amounts to is constancy of character.  How could the constancy of the Second Person’s character entail that he would not change when assuming the human nature?   What does that have to do with whether Christ’s “flesh was turned into the nature of the godhead or that the unspeakable Word of God was changed into the nature of the flesh”?  The change being ruled out at Ephesus is not moral change or change of character, but change of properties and change of nature.  So the early church councils don’t have the constancy of character view in mind when they claim that God is immutable.  If they had such a view in mind, they wouldn’t have thought to point to divine immutability in support of the claim that Christ didn’t change in becoming incarnate.

In regard to the later church councils and confessional statements, they don’t define the meaning of “immutability” when they assert it in the list of divine attributes.  Again, however, one notices that they do not put the affirmation of divine immutability in discussion of God’s character but in discussion of God’s existence.  One finds immutability in a list of other nonmoral attributes, and not subjugated to the affirmation that God is wholly good or holy.

For instance, the Fourth council of Constantinople teaches that God is immutable and unchangeable, and this not in relation to God’s character but in discussion of God’s very existence (“ever existing without beginning, and eternal, ever the same and like to himself, and suffering no change or alteration….”).  The claim of immutability isn’t made in relation to God’s moral character but in a list of affirmations concerning God’s mode of existence.

So, for the reasons given in the preceding paragraphs, divine immutability, taken in its traditional sense, should not be understood to mean merely constancy of character.  Surely constancy of character is a part of the concept.  But divine immutability must be more robust than that to do the work it has been tapped to do in traditional Christianity.

b. Strong Immutability—God Does Not Change in Any Way

A stronger understanding of divine immutability is that God is literally unable to change.  As Thomas Aquinas, a commonly cited proponent of this view, says: God is “altogether immutable…it is impossible for God to be in any way changeable” (Summa Theologiae, the First Part, Question nine, Article one, the response; the quotation is from the translation at newadvent.org). God doesn’t change by coming to be or ceasing to be; by gaining or losing qualities; by any quantitative growth or diminishment; by learning or forgetting anything; by starting or stopping willing what he wills; or in any other way that requires going from being one way to being another.

Whenever a proposition about God changes truth-value, the reason for the change in truth-value of the proposition is not, on this view of immutability, because of a change in God, but because of some other change in something else. (I speak here of a proposition changing its truth-value, though it is not essential for divine immutability that propositions can change truth-values.  If the reader holds a view where propositions have their truth-values eternally, the reader may substitute in his or her preferred paraphrase for apparent change in the truth-value of propositions.)  Father Jones is praising God, and so the proposition that God is being praised by Father Jones is true.  Later that same proposition is no longer true, but not because of any change in God.  It is no longer true because Father Jones stopped praising God, and not because God is in any way different than he was.  Likewise in other situations: God doesn’t go from being one way to being another; rather, something else changes and on account of that a proposition about God changes its truth-value.

One may wonder about the viability of this account when it deals with events that clearly seem to involve God doing something.  For instance, God talked to Abraham at a certain time in history.  Consider the proposition: God is talking to Abraham.  That was true at one point (Hagar might have whispered it to Ishmael after the youth asked what his father was doing).  At other times, God is not talking to Abraham.  But isn’t the change here a change in what God is doing?  Doesn’t God go from talking to not talking to Abraham?  And if so, how does that fit with the claim made in the previous paragraph, that changes in propositions about God are due to changes in things besides God?

The defender of strong immutability will draw a distinction here between the actions of God and their effects.  God, on this view, is unchangingly performing his divine action or actions, but the effects come and go.  Compare: In one swift action I throw a barrel full of messages in bottles overboard in the middle of the Atlantic.  This action of mine has multiple effects: it causes waves and ripples as the bottles hit the water.  Later, it causes other effects as people read the messages I’ve sent.  I convey some information to those whom the bottles reach, but the action I performed to do so has long since ceased.  Depending on one’s view of divine simplicity and divine eternity, some aspects of this analogy will have to be changed.  But the point remains: one action can have multiple effects at multiple times.  God immutably acts to talk with Abraham, and either does so atemporally or, if God is inside of time, has always and will always so act.  The changing of the truth-value of the proposition that God is talking to Abraham is not due to God changing, on this theory, but due to the effects of God’s action coming and going.

Strong immutability has a few things going for it.  First, it is congruent with the final four passages of Scripture cited in section 1.  If God is strongly immutable, he cannot change his mind, and he also cannot change.  So these last four passages pose no problem on this understanding of immutability.

Also, this stronger notion of immutability does the work needed for the early councils, which point to immutability to show that the Second Person of the Trinity does not change when assuming the human nature.  The conciliar reference to divine immutability is understandable if immutability is understood as strong immutability, whereas it is not understandable if it is understood in the weaker constancy of character sense.

Finally, this strong understanding of divine immutability is very common in church history. Just like the constancy of character model of divine immutability, however, this understanding is not without its own problems.  First it has to provide a way of understanding the first two scripture citations, as well as the many others where God appears to change. Furthermore, it has other difficulties, which are consider in the following section.

3. Objections to Strong Immutability

There are many objections to the strong view of divine immutability, some of which were discussed in the previous section, including changes which appear to be changes in God, but which, on this view, are parsed as changes in other things, such as the effects of the unchanging divine action.  This section discusses some other objections to strong immutability.

a. God’s Knowledge of Temporally Indexed Truths, Omniscience and Immutability

Here is a truth that I know:  that it is now 2:23pm.  That is something I couldn’t know a minute ago, and it is something that I won’t know in a minute.  At that time, I’ll know a different truth: that it is now 2:24pm.  Either God knows such temporally indexed truths—truths that include reference to particular times at which they are true—or not.  If God does not know such truths, then he is not omniscient, since there is something to be known—something a lowly creature like me does, in fact, know—of which God is ignorant.  Since very few theists, especially of a traditional stripe, are willing to give up divine omniscience, very few will be willing to claim that God is ignorant of temporally changing truths like truths about what time it is.

If God is omniscient, then God knows such temporally changing truths.  If God does know such temporally changing truths, then God changes, since God goes from knowing that it is now 2:23pm to knowing that it is now 2:24pm.  And worse, God changes with much more frequency, since there are more fine-grained truths to know about time than which minute it is (for instance, what second it is, what millisecond it is, etc.)  If God knows such truths at some times but not at others, God changes.  And if God changes, divine immutability is false.  So if God is omniscient, he is not immutable.  Therefore, God is either not immutable or not omniscient.  And since both views are explicitly held by traditional Christianity (and other monotheisms) there is a problem here for the traditional proponent of divine immutability.  This argument was put forward forcefully by Norman Kretzmann in his article Omniscience and Immutability (1966).

There are a few common responses to this argument.  First, one can claim that in order to be omniscient, God needn’t know indexed truths as indexed truths.  Second, one might claim that knowledge is not an intrinsic state or property, and that God’s immutability extends only to God’s intrinsic properties.  Third, one might argue that God does not know in the same way that we know, and this problem arises only if God knows things by being acquainted with particular propositions, as we know things.  Fourth, one might respond by assuming God is atemporally eternal and distinguishing the present-tensed terms in the premises between the eternal and temporal present.

Consider the first response.  God needn’t know that now it is 2:23pm.  Rather he knows the same fact under a non-temporally-indexed description.  For instance, God knows that the expression of this proposition, that it is now 2:23pm, is simultaneous with a state that, by convention, we call 2:23pm.  Such knowledge of simultaneity doesn’t require a temporal indexing, and so doesn’t require change across time.  One may wonder here, though, whether indexicals can be eliminated from all indexed propositions without any change in the meaning of the propositions. (For more on whether knowledge of indexical propositions can be reduced to knowledge of nonindexed propositions, see John Perry (1979).)

The second response is put forward by Brian Leftow.  Leftow understands divine immutability as the doctrine that God undergoes no change of intrinsic properties.  Intrinsic properties are properties that involve only the bearer of that property, or, put another way, properties that a thing would have even if it were the only thing in existence, or, put another way, properties a thing would have that don’t require other things to have particular properties (Leftow, 2004). My shape is a property intrinsic to me, as is my being rational.  If you could quarantine me from the influence of everything else, I’d still have my bodily shape and my rationality.  My distance from the Eiffel Tower or height relative to my little cousin, however, are extrinsic properties, since they require the existence of certain things and their having particular properties.  By changing something else and leaving me the same—let my cousin grow for a few more years—you can change my extrinsic properties.  But not so with my intrinsic properties. (This is a rough understanding of intrinsic properties, since if you quarantined me off from the influence of everything I wouldn’t have air to breathe, wouldn’t be under the influence of gravity, light, or anything else.  What it is to be intrinsic is notoriously difficult to define.  For more on intrinsic properties, see David Denby (2006).)

Is God’s knowledge intrinsic or extrinsic to God?  On this definition of intrinsic, God’s knowledge of creatures is extrinsic.  For instance, God’s being such that he knows that it is now 2:24pm entails that something else (for instance, the universe, or the present) has a property (for instance, to give some examples from Leftow (2008), being a certain age, or being a certain temporal distance from the first instant). Likewise for God’s knowledge of other changing facts; since God’s knowing that a is F, where a is not God, entails something about another being having a property—namely, it entails that a is F—such properties of God are extrinsic.  Hence God’s going from knowing that a is F to knowing that a is not F does not require an intrinsic change, and thus is not contrary to divine immutability.

This response faces a difficulty because even if God’s knowledge of other things is extrinsic, since it entails properties in things other than God, belief is not extrinsic.  My knowledge of who is in the adjoining office changes when people come and go, since knowledge entails truth, and the truth of who is there changes.  But my belief of who is there, having no necessary relation to truth, can remain constant even across change in truth-values.  This shows that even if knowledge is intrinsic, since it fluctuates with truth, belief is not extrinsic, since beliefs can be as they are whether or not the world is as they present it.

So even if God’s knowledge of creatures is extrinsic, God’s beliefs concerning creatures are intrinsic, since they don’t require anything of creatures.  This suggests that the intrinsic/extrinsic distinction will not save strong immutability from an argument from changing truths based on beliefs rather than knowledge.  In response to an argument run from beliefs rather than knowledge, one might point out that God believes all and only what is true.  Thus God’s beliefs about creatures, and not merely his knowledge about them, will be extrinsic. This is because God believes something if and only if he knows it, and he knows it if and only if it is true: God’s belief that a is F entails, and is entailed by, that a is F.

A second difficulty with Leftow’s response is that knowing and believing seem to be quintessential intrinsic properties, which might lead one to reject this understanding of intrinsic properties.  A third problem is that this view, far from keeping God unchanging, instead has some of his properties changing every instant, since he extrinsically changes with every passing instant.  If change of a property entails change full stop, and it seems to, then God is continually changing on this view.  A fourth and final problem is that this answer is inconsistent with another traditional attribute of God—atemporality.  An atemporal God cannot change at all, since change requires time.  So even if this response can answer the other problems, the proponent of divine eternality, and this includes Leftow, will not be able to embrace this response.

Tom Sullivan champions the third response. He argues that the problem arises due to a misunderstanding of how God knows.  We know by being properly related to certain thoughts or propositions.  So when the time changes, the proposition or thought we need to be related to in order to know the truth changes.  But if God does not know by being related to propositions, but in some other sui generis way that doesn’t require change in relation to propositions, then the problem may be defused (Sullivan, 1991).

This is a negative response, since it only says we don’t know as God knows, and doesn’t spell out the mode of knowing that God has.  And this counts against the response, since it doesn’t give us a way of understanding how God knows.  By being undeveloped, it is hard to analyze its merits.  Nevertheless, if it is true that God knows in a way unique to him, then that way may help solve the problem.

A final response is due to Eleonore Stump and Norman Kretzmann. Their response assumes divine eternity, which implies, in part, that God is atemporal.  They argue that the claim that God knows what time it is now is ambiguous between four readings, depending on whether the “knows” is understood as an eternally present or temporally present verb, and depending on whether the now refers to the temporal now or the atemporal now.  Thus, God knows (eternally or temporally) what time it is now (that is, in the temporal present or the eternal present).  Nothing can know what time it is in the eternal present, since in the eternal present there is no time.  So we must understand the sense of ‘now’ to be ranging over the temporal present and not the eternal present.  God, since eternal, cannot know at the present time, but must know eternally.  So the only viable reading of the four possible readings is God knows eternally what is happening in the temporal present.  Consider the following inference introduced earlier: “If God does know such temporally changing truths, then God changes, since God goes from knowing that it is now 2:23pm to knowing that it is now 2:24pm.”  This inference, Stump and Kretzmann claim, does not hold when it is disambiguated as they disambiguate it.  For God eternally knows that at different times different truths are true, for instance, that it is now (at the temporal present) a certain time, but he knows these truths in one unchanging, atemporal action.  God’s eternal knowledge not only doesn’t allow for change; it positively rules change out, since change is inconsistent with eternity.  God eternally knows what is happening now, and at every other time, but in so knowing doesn’t go from being one way to being another.  Rather God simultaneously knows (on the assumption of divine eternity) in one act of knowing all temporally indexed truths (Stump and Kretzmann, 1981, p 455-458).

This response requires the assumption of divine eternity, which may be a cost for some defenders of divine immutability.  Also, it requires an understanding of simultaneity that can allow for God to be simultaneous with all times, but not entail that all times be simultaneous. Stump and Kretzmann offer such an account of simultaneity. (For more on this topic, see Leftow (1991) chapters 14 and 15.)

b. Immutability and Modal Collapse

One might worry that strong immutability leads to a modal collapse—that whatever is actually the case is necessary and whatever is not the case is impossible.  For, one might think, if it is impossible that God change, then no matter what happens, God will be the same.  So, no matter what happens, God will talk to Abraham at a certain time.  God can’t change to do anything else.  And if God can’t change to do anything else, then it seems like he’s stuck doing what he does, knowing what he knows, desiring what he desires, and so on, come what may.  And if that’s true, it is a small step to saying nothing could be different than it is, since if God hadn’t talked to Abraham at a certain time, God would be different.  And if God were different, he would be mutable.

The key to responding to this objection is to draw a distinction between being different in different circumstances and changing.  Divine immutability rules out that God go from being one way to being another way.  But it does not rule out God knowing, desiring, or acting differently than he does.  It is possible that God not create anything.  If God hadn’t created anything, he wouldn’t talk to Abraham at a certain time (since no Abraham would exist).  But such a scenario doesn’t require that God change, since it doesn’t require that there be a time when God is one way, and a later time when he is different.  Rather, it just requires the counterfactual difference that if God had not created, he would not talk to Abraham.  Such a truth is neutral to whether or not God changes.  In short, difference across possible worlds does not entail difference across times.  Since all that strong immutability rules out is difference across times, divine immutability is not inconsistent with counterfactual difference, and hence does not entail a modal collapse.  Things could have been otherwise than they are, and, had they been different, God would immutably know things other than he does, all without change (to see more on this, see Stump (2003) p 109-115.) In the words of one Catholic dogmatist:

Because of His unchangeableness God cannot revoke what he has once freely decreed,—such decisions, for instance, as to create a visible world, to redeem the human race, to permit Christ to die on the cross, etc.—though it is possible, of course, that some other Economy different from the present might be governed by entirely different divine decrees (Pohle, 1946, p 283).

One might still have worries about modal collapse here, especially if one affirms the doctrine of divine simplicity along with strong immutability, as most proponents of strong immutability do.

As I’ve argued, strong immutability rules out differences across times, but not across possible situations or worlds (or Economies, as Pohle has it).  The doctrine of divine simplicity—the thesis that in God there is no composition whatsoever, that God is uniquely metaphysically simple—seems to rule out difference across possible worlds. For what is there in God to be different if God is wholly simple?  So it seems that these two doctrines together rule out God’s being different at all, either across time or across worlds, and so, together, they seem to entail a modal collapse.

The first thing to note here is that, even if it is true that the doctrines of divine simplicity and strong immutability together entail a modal collapse—and there is good reason to be suspicious of this claim—the doctrine of divine simplicity is doing all the work in entailing the modal collapse.  This is because it, and it alone, seems to entail that God is the same in all possible worlds—strong immutability is silent on this point.  The second thing to note here is that the doctrine of divine simplicity can be understood in many different ways, some of which do not require simplicity to entail modal collapse.  Enumerating and defending these ways, however, is beyond the scope of this entry. (For two such understandings of divine simplicity, see Stump (2003), p 109-115, and Brower (2008)).

c. Responsiveness and an Immutable God

Adherents to the three great monotheisms, as well as other theists, traditionally believe that God answers prayers.  Answering prayers requires a response to the actions of another (in particular, a response to a petition).  Here is an argument that begins with responsiveness and concludes to a mutable God.  God is responsive to prayers.  Anything that is responsive, in responding, undergoes change.  Thus if God responds to prayers, then God undergoes change.  If God undergoes change, then God is not immutable.  Therefore, if God responds to prayers, then God is not immutable.

One response to this argument is to define immutability in the weaker sense of constancy of character (the discussion here follows Eleonore Stump’s treatment of divine responsiveness in her book Aquinas (Stump, 2003, p 115-118).  See also Stump and Kretzmann, “Eternity,” especially pages 450-451).  Immutability, so defined, does not rule out responsiveness to prayers.  In fact, it might be God’s character that accounts for divine responsiveness.  The defender of the strong immutability, however, will have to make a different reply.  Since she will affirm that God responds to prayers, she will reject the claim that responsiveness requires change.  One way to support such a rejection is to provide an analysis of responsiveness that doesn’t require change across time.  Here are two such analyses:

J is responsive to T’s request to x if and only if J does x because T requested it.

J is responsive to T’s request to x if and only if J does x, and J might not have done x if T didn’t request it.

If either of these two closely related views is correct, then responsiveness doesn’t require temporal priority or change.  Notice that nothing in these two understandings of responsiveness requires change in the part of a responder.  In many cases where someone changes in responding it is, in part, due to her gaining new knowledge or having to prepare to respond.  But suppose that there was no point in her existence where she didn’t know that to which she responds or isn’t prepared to respond.  It might be hard to imagine what that would be like for a human, since we humans were once ignorant, powerless babes.  But suppose a person were omniscient and omnipotent for all of his existence.  God, since omniscient, knows of all petitions, and, since omnipotent, needn’t ever prepare to answer a petition.  So God doesn’t fall under the conditions that humans fall under which require change on their parts to respond.  God can be immutably responding to the petitions of his followers.  That is, God can act in certain ways because his followers ask him to, and he might not have acted that way had they not asked.  But he doesn’t need to change in order to do so.

What responsiveness does require is counterfactual difference.  That is, had the circumstances been different than they are, then God might have done differently.  And that’s true.  Had Monica not asked for Augustine’s conversion, and God saved Augustine, at least in part, because Monica asked him to, God might not have converted Augustine.  All this leads to an important point: responsiveness is a modal, not temporal, concept.  That is, responsiveness has to do with difference across possible situations and not change across times. To respond is to do something because of something else.  Since we’ve seen in the previous objection that divine immutability does not rule out counterfactual difference, responsiveness is not ruled out by immutability.  While in very many cases it seems that responsiveness will require change, it does not require change in situations where the responder need not gain knowledge and need not prepare to respond.

d. Personhood and Immutability

Some thinkers have claimed that there is an inconsistency in something’s being both a person and unchanging.  One reason for thinking that personhood and immutability are inconsistent is that being a person requires being able to respond, and responsiveness is not possible for something immutable.  That objection was already discussed in the proceeding section.  But there are other reasons for thinking that personhood and immutability are inconsistent.

Richard Swinburne claims that personhood and immutability are inconsistent because immutability is inconsistent with responsiveness, as the previous objection had it, and additionally because immutability is inconsistent with freedom.  God is free, and, according to Swinburne:

[A]n agent is perfectly free at a certain time if his action results from his own choice at that time and if his choice is not itself brought about by anything else.  Yet a person immutable in the strong sense would be unable to perform any action at a certain time other than what he had previously intended to do.  His course of action being fixed by his past choices, he would not be perfectly free (Swinburne, 1993, p 222).

A strongly immutable God cannot be free, and God is perfectly free, so God is not strongly immutable.

One response to this problem is to invoke divine timelessness.  If God is outside of time, this passage, which is about things that are “free at a certain time” does not apply to God. Furthermore, if we were to drop the “at a certain time” from the text, the proponent of divine timelessness would still have a response to this argument.  Given that God is atemporal, it isn’t true of God that he “previously intended to do” anything.  There are no previous or later intentions for an atemporal being—they are all at once.  Likewise, he would have no “past choices” to fix his actions.  So this argument is not applicable to an atemporal, immutable person.

Even for a temporally located immutable person, there are still responses to this argument.  The perfectly free, temporally located, immutable person needn’t have his actions brought about by anything else besides his own choices.  Such an agent can still fulfill the criterion set out by Swinburne for being perfectly free.  God’s immutable action is brought about by his own choice at a time, and his choice is not brought about by any previous things, including previous choices.  Swinburne is right that God’s past choices would bring about his present actions (being immutable, God’s choices can’t change, so the past choices are identical with the present choices), but he is wrong in thinking that his choice is brought about by previous things.  For the choice of a temporal, immutable God is everlastingly the exact same (if God goes from choosing one thing to not choosing that thing, he is not immutable).  God’s action is everlastingly the same, and everlastingly brought about by God’s choice, which is also everlastingly the same.  God’s course of action is, as Swinburne says, fixed by past choices, but those past choices are identical with the current choices, and the choices are not brought about by anything else.  So such a being will fulfill the definition of what it is to be perfectly free.

One might also think that personhood requires rationality, consciousness, the ability to communicate, and being self-conscious (William Mann, 1983, p 269-272). Notice that none of these properties are inconsistent with immutability.  Some aspects of human rationality and consciousness aren’t available for an immutable person, for example, getting angry, learning something new, or becoming aware of a situation.  That doesn’t entail that an immutable person cannot be rational or conscious at all.  Rather, it means that the aspects of rationality or consciousness that require temporal change are ruled out.  But an immutable God can still be aware of what Moses does, still respond in a way we can call wrathful, and still love Moses.  Such actions are clear cases of rationality and consciousness and none of them require, as a necessary condition, change in the agent.

e. Immutability, Time, and Freedom

Suppose that God is in time, but immutable.  That means his knowledge can’t change over time, as discussed in a previous objection.  So anything God knows now, he knew a thousand years ago.  And here’s one thing that God knows now: what I freely chose to eat for breakfast yesterday.  I know such a truth, so God can’t be ignorant of it.  Given immutability, God can’t go from not knowing it to knowing it.  So he has everlastingly known it.  Similarly for all other truths.  In general, God knows what we are going to do before we do it.

If God knows before I act that I am going to act in that way, then I can’t do anything but act in that way.  And if, for every one of my actions, I can’t do otherwise, then I can’t be free.  Put another way, God’s knowledge ten thousand years ago that I would do thus-and-such entails that now I do thus-and-such.  And that’s true of all my actions.  So God’s knowledge determines all of my actions.

The proponent of an eternal, immutable God doesn’t face this problem, since on that view God doesn’t, strictly speaking, know anything before anything else.  Likewise, someone who denies immutability may get around this objection by affirming that God changes to learn new facts as time marches on.  But the defender of a temporal, immutable God has neither of these options available.

One response open to the defender of a temporal, immutable God is to embrace the view, presented above in section 3.a, that immutability doesn’t rule out extrinsic change, and gaining or losing knowledge is extrinsic change.  The benefits and costs of this view were discussed above.

Another response would be to argue that there is an asymmetry between truths and the world which allows for prior logical determination not to render a posterior action unfree. Truths are true because reality is as it is, and not the other way around.  So the truth of God’s knowledge that I do thus-and-such is because I do thus-and-such, and not the converse.  In order to get unfree action, one must have one’s actions be done because of something else, such as force.  Since the dependence of truth on reality requires the “because of” relations to run the other way, actions entailed by the truth of earlier truths do not render such actions unfree. ( Trenton Merricks, 2009; see also Kevin Timpe, 2007).

A final response is to claim that God knows all the actions that I will do, and he knew them far before I do actually perform those actions, but, were I to freely do something else, he would have known differently than he does.  This answer requires backwards counterfactual dependence of God’s knowledge on future actions.  But it doesn’t, at least without much argument, require backwards causation. This view is known as Ockham’s Way Out, and was popularized in an article by Alvin Plantinga (1986) entitled, aptly, “On Ockham’s Way Out.”

4. Related Issues

There are both philosophical and theological issues related to divine immutability.  Some theological issues include the relationship between immutability and other attributes and the consistency of God becoming man yet being strongly immutable.  As for philosophically related issues, one is the issue discussed above in section 3.e: the issue of (theological) determinism and free will.  Another relevant issue is the distinction, so important to Leftow’s understanding of immutability (see section 3.a), between intrinsic and extrinsic properties.

a. Divine Timelessness or Eternality

As is clear from the responses to some objections in section 3, supposing that God is outside of time has some advantages when it comes to answering objections to divine immutability (Mann, 1983). Divine timelessness entails divine immutability, given that change has as a necessary condition time in which to change.  But running the entailment relation the other way—from immutability to timelessness—is more difficult.  If one can show that existing in time requires at least one sort of intrinsic change—if, for instance, change in age or duration of existence is intrinsic change—then one can argue that immutability and temporality are inconsistent (Leftow, 2004). For arguments from immutability to timelessness, see Leftow (2004).

b. Divine Impassibility

Divine impassibility is the claim that God cannot have affects, or be affected by things.  Paul Gavrilyuk describes it as follows:

[T]hat [God] does not have the same emotions as the gods of the heathen; that his care for human beings is free from self-interest and any association with evil; that since he has neither body nor soul, he cannot directly have the experiences typically connected with them; that he is not overwhelmed by emotions and in the incarnation emerges victorious over suffering and death (Gavrilyuk (2004) 15-16; for other definitions of the term, see Creel (1986) 3-10).

Notice that impassibility, as so described, doesn’t entail immutability.  An agent can be impassible in the sense described by Gavrilyuk but still mutable.  He can, for instance, change in going from not promising to promising and be impassible.  Likewise, an immutable God can be passible.  He can be continually undergoing an emotion without change—for instance, he could be continually feeling the sorrow over human sin without change (Leftow, 2004). Neither entails the other. Nevertheless, they are closely related and often discussed in tandem.

c. The Incarnation

The incarnation is the doctrine, central to Christianity, that the Son of God, the Second Person of the Trinity, assumed a full human nature (that is, all that there is to a human), and became man.  Thus the one divine person had two natures—one divine, and one human, each with its own intellect and will, and these two natures didn’t mix together or exclude one another.  For the most important traditional expression of this doctrine, see the council of Chalcedon.  (Though it must be said that the doctrine wasn’t fully developed—in particular, the parts about Christ having two wills—until later councils.)

The incarnation raises questions concerning the immutability of God insofar as in the incarnation the Second Person of the Trinity becomes a man, and becoming, at least on the face of it, appears to involve change.  So the incarnation, it has been argued, is inconsistent with divine immutability.

This is not the place to go into a theological discussion of the consistency of the two teachings.  One should note, however, that the very church fathers and councils that teach that Christ’s two natures didn’t change one another or mix together, provide as evidence, as we saw in sections 1.b and 2, that God is absolutely unchangeable by his very nature.  So the principle of charity dictates that if we do find ourselves understanding immutability and the incarnation such that there is an explicit, obvious contradiction between them, noticeable by the merest reflection upon the two doctrines, the chances are that it is our understanding, and not the traditional doctrine’s, that is at fault. To see more on the relationship between the incarnation and immutability, see Richards (2003) p 209-210 and Dodds (1986) p 272-277.  Stump (2003) chapter 14 is helpful here as well.  Also, see Weinandy (1985), which is a book-length discussion of this very question.

d. Intrinsic/Extrinsic Properties

The distinction between intrinsic and extrinsic properties is important to the discussion of divine immutability because there needs to be a way to distinguish between the predications concerning God which can change in truth-value without precluding divine immutability and those that can’t.  This was discussed in sections 2.b and 3.a.  Divine immutability is compromised if that God is planning to redeem creation changes in truth-value, but it is not compromised if that God is being praised by Father Jones changes in truth-value.  The difference between propositions of these two sorts is often spelled out in terms of intrinsic and extrinsic properties (oftentimes extrinsic changes are called Cambridge changes).  God’s plans are intrinsic to God, but his being praised is extrinsic to him (unless he is praising himself).

5. References and Further Reading

  • Brower, Jeffrey. “Making Sense of Divine Simplicity”. Faith and Philosophy 25(1) 2008. p 3-30.
  • Creel, Richard. Divine Impassibility. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1986.
  • Denby, David. “The Distinction between Intrinsic and Extrinsic Properties”. Mind: A Quarterly Review of Philosophy 115(457) 2006. p 1-17.
  • Dodds, Michael. The Unchanging God of Love: a Study of the Teaching of St. Thomas Aquinas on Divine Immutability in View of Certain Contemporary Criticism of This Doctrine. Fribourg: Editions Universitaires, 1986.
    • This book provides a detailed and historical look at Thomas Aquinas’ understanding of immutability, as well as defending it against objections.
  • Dorner, I. and Robert Williams. Divine Immutability. Minneapolis: Fortress Press, 1994.
    • This is an important work on immutability by a 19th century theologian, which receives more attention in theological than in philosophical contexts.
  • Gavrilyuk, Paul. The Suffering of the Impassible God. Oxford Oxfordshire: Oxford University Press, 2004.
    • This is a good, recent discussion of divine impassibility.
  • Kretzmann, Norman. “Omniscience and Immutability”. Journal of Philosophy 63(14) 1966. p 409-421.
  • Leftow, Brian.  “Eternity and Immutability.” The Blackwell Guide to Philosophy of Religion.  Mann, William E.  Blackwell Publishing, 2004.
    • This is an excellent article on divine immutability and eternality from a philosophical viewpoint.
  • Leftow, Brian. “Immutability”. The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Fall 2008 Edition), Edward N. Zalta (ed.).
    • This, too, is an excellent article on divine immutability from a philosophical viewpoint.
  • Leftow, Brian. Time and Eternity. Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 1991.
    • This book provides a technical, extended discussion of divine eternality, its entailments, and arguments for and against it.
  • Mann, William. “Simplicity and Immutability in God”. International Philosophical Quarterly 23, 1983. p 267-276.
    • This article argues that divine immutability is best understood in the light of divine eternality and simplicity.  It also includes a nice discussion of immutability and personhood.
  • Merricks, Trenton.  “Truth and Freedom”. Philosophical Review 118(1), 2009. p 29-57.
  • Perry, John. “The Problem of the Essential Indexical”. Noûs 13, 1979. p 3-21.
  • Plantinga, Alvin. “On Ockham’s Way Out”. Faith and Philosophy 3(3) 1986. p 235-269.
  • Pohle, Joseph and Arthur Preuss.  God: His Knowability, Essence, and Attributes.  St. Louis, MO: Herder Book Co, 1946.
    • This is volume from a standard dogmatic set, which contains biblical, patristic, and philosophical arguments for Catholic dogmas.
  • Richards, Jay. The Untamed God. Downers Grove: InterVarsity Press, 2003.
    • This book is about divine immutability and simplicity.  It is written at a good level for a beginner, but contains discussion useful for advanced readers as well.
  • Schaff, Philip.  The Creeds of Christendom: The Evangelical Protestant Creeds, with Translations. Harper, 1877.
    • This is a useful collection of confessional statements from the protestant reformers and their successors.
  • Stump, Eleonore. Aquinas. New York: Routledge, 2003.
    • An excellent discussion of Aquinas’s philosophy, which includes extended discussions of divine responsiveness, immutability, simplicity, and eternality.
  • Stump, Eleonore, and Norman Kretzmann, “Eternity”. Journal of Philosophy 78, 1981. p 429-458.
    • A seminal article on the relationship between time and God.
  • Sullivan, Thomas D.  “Omniscience, Immutability, and the Divine Mode of Knowing”. Faith and Philosophy 8(1) 1991. p 21-35.
  • Swinburne, Richard. The Coherence of Theism. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1993.
  • Tanner, Norman. Decrees of the Ecumenical Councils. Franklin: Sheed & Ward, 1990.
    • An excellent two volume work which contains the decrees of the councils in the original languages, with facing translations.
  • Timpe, Kevin. “Truthmaking and Divine Eternity”. Religious Studies 43(3) 2007. p 299-315.
  • Weinandy, Thomas. Does God Change?. Still River: St. Bede’s Publications, 1985.
    • This book is an interesting historical discussion of what it means to say that God is immutable but became man.
  • Williams, Robert R., “I. A Dorner: The Ethical Immutability of God”. Journal of the American Academy of Religion 54(4), 1986. p 721-738.

Author Information

Tim Pawl
Email: timpawl@stthomas.edu
University of Saint Thomas
U. S. A.

Paraconsistent Logic

A paraconsistent logic is a way to reason about inconsistent information without lapsing into absurdity. In a non-paraconsistent logic, inconsistency explodes in the sense that if a contradiction obtains, then everything (everything!) else obtains, too. Someone reasoning with a paraconsistent logic can begin with inconsistent premises—say, a moral dilemma, a Kantian antinomy, or a semantic paradox—and still reach sensible conclusions, without completely exploding into incoherence.

Paraconsistency is a thesis about logical consequence: not every contradiction entails arbitrary absurdities. Beyond that minimal claim, views and mechanics of paraconsistent logic come in a broad spectrum, from weak to strong, as follows.

On the very weak end, paraconsistent logics are taken to be safeguards to control for human fallibility. We inevitably revise our theories, have false beliefs, and make mistakes; to prevent falling into incoherence, a paraconsistent logic is required. Such modest and conservative claims say nothing about truth per se. Weak paraconsistency is still compatible with the thought that if a contradiction were true, then everything would be true, too—because, beliefs and theories notwithstanding, contradictions cannot be true.

On the very strong end of the spectrum, paraconsistent logics underwrite the claim that some contradictions really are true. This thesis—dialetheism—is that sometimes the best theory (of mathematics, or metaphysics, or even the empirical world) is contradictory. Paraconsistency is mandated because the dialetheist still maintains that not everything is true. In fact, strong paraconsistency maintains that all contradictions are false—even though some contradictions also are true. Thus, at this end of the spectrum, dialetheism is itself one of the true contradictions.

This article offers a brief discussion of some main ideas and approaches to paraconsistency. Modern logics are couched in the language of mathematics and formal symbolism. Nevertheless, this article is not a tutorial on the technical aspects of paraconsistency, but rather a synopsis of the underlying ideas. See the  suggested readings for formal expositions, as well as historical material.

Table of Contents

  1. The Problem
  2. Logical Background
    1. Definitions
    2. Two Grades of Paraconsistency
    3. Requirements for a Logic to Be Paraconsistent
  3. Schools of Paraconsistent Logic
    1. Discussive Logic
    2. Preservationism
    3. Adaptive Logic
    4. Relevance
    5. Logics of Formal Inconsistency
    6. Dialetheism
  4. Applications
    1. Moral Dilemmas
    2. Law, Science, and Belief Revision
    3. Closed Theories – Truth and Sets
      1. Naïve Axioms
      2. Further Logical Restrictions
    4. Learning, Beliefs, and AI
  5. Conclusion
  6. References and Further Reading

1. The Problem

Consider an example due to Alan Weir, concerning a political leader who absolutely, fundamentally believes in the sanctity of human life, and so believes that war is always wrong. All the same, a situation arises where her country must enter into war (else people will die, which is wrong). Entering into war will inevitably mean that some people will die. Plausibly, the political leader is now embroiled in a dilemma. This is exactly when paraconsistent inference is appropriate. Imagine our leader thinking, ‘War is always wrong, but since we are going to war anyway, we may as well bomb civilians.’ Absurdist reasoning of this sort is not only bad logic, but just plain old bad.

David Hume once wrote (1740, p. 633),

I find myself involv’d in such a labyrinth, that, I must confess, I neither know how to correct my former opinions, nor how to render them consistent.

As Schotch and Jennings rightly point out, ‘it is no good telling Hume that if his inconsistent opinions were, all of them, true then every sentence would be true.’ The best we could tell Hume is that at least some of his opinions are wrong—but ‘this, so far from being news to Hume, was what occasioned much of the anguish he evidently felt’ (Schotch et al. p. 23). We want a way to keep sensible and reasonable even when—especially when—such problems arise. We need a way to keep from falling to irrational pieces when life, logic, mathematics or even philosophy leads us into paradox and conundrum. That is what paraconsistent logics are for.

2. Logical Background

a. Definitions

A logic is a set of well-formed formulae, along with an inference relation ⊢. The inference relation, also called logical consequence, may be specified syntactically or semantically, and tells us which formulae (conclusions) follow from which formulae (premises). When a sentence B follows from a bunch of sentences A0, A1, …, An, we write

A0, A1, …, An ⊢ B.

When the relation ⊢ holds, we say that the inference is valid. The set of all sentences that can be validly inferred in a logic is called a theory.

A key distinction behind the entire paraconsistent enterprise is that between consistency and coherence. A theory is consistent if no pairs of contradictory sentences A, ¬A are derivable, or alternatively iff no single sentence of the form A & ¬A is derivable. Coherence is a broader notion, sometimes called absolute (as opposed to simple) consistency, and more often called non-triviality. A trivial or absurd theory is one in which absolutely every sentence holds. The idea of paraconsistency is that coherence is possible even without consistency. Put another way, a paraconsistent logician can say that a theory is inconsistent without meaning that the theory is incoherent, or absurd. The former is a structural feature of the theory, worth repair or further study; the latter means the theory has gone disastrously wrong. Paraconsistency gives us a principled way to resist equating contradiction with absurdity.

In classical logic, the logic developed by Boole, Frege, Russell et al. in the late 1800s, and the logic almost always taught in university courses, has an inference relation according to which

A, ¬A ⊢ B

is valid. Here the conclusion, B, could be absolutely anything at all. Thus this inference is called ex contradictione quodlibet (from a contradiction, everything follows) or explosion. Paraconsistent logicians have urged that this feature of classical inference is incorrect. While the reasons for denying the validity of explosion will vary according to one’s view of the role of logic, a basic claim is that the move from a contradiction to an arbitrary formula does not seem like reasoning. As the founders of relevant logic, Anderson and Belnap, urge in their canonical book Entailment, a ‘proof’ submitted to a mathematics journal in which the essential steps fail to provide a reason to believe the conclusion, e.g. a proof by explosion, would be rejected out of hand. Mark Colyvan (2008) illustrates the point by noting that no one has laid claim to a startlingly simple proof of the Riemann hypothesis:

Riemann’s Hypothesis: All the zeros of the zeta function have real part equal to 1/2.
Proof: Let R stand for the Russell set, the set of all sets that are not members of themselves. It is straightforward to show that this set is both a member of itself and not a member of itself. Therefore, all the zeros of Riemann’s zeta function have real part equal to 1/2.

Needless to say, the Riemann hypothesis remains an open problem at time of writing.

Minimally, paraconsistent logicians claim that there are or may be situations in which paraconsistency is a viable alternative to classical logic. This is a pluralist view, by which different logics are appropriate to different areas. Just as a matter of practical value, explosion does not seem like good advice for a person who is faced with a contradiction, as the quote from Hume above makes clear. More forcefully, paraconsistent logics make claim to being a better account of logic than the classical apparatus. This is closer to a monistic view, in which there is, essentially, one correct logic, and it is paraconsistent.

b. Two Grades of Paraconsistency

Let us have a formal definition of paraconsistency.

Definition 1. A logic is paraconsistent iff it is not the case for all sentences A, B that A, ¬A ⊢ B.

This definition simply is the denial of ex contradictione quodlibet; a logic is paraconsistent iff it does not validate explosion. The definition is neutral as to whether any inconsistency will ever arise. It only indicates that, were an inconsistency to arise, this would not necessarily lead to inferential explosion. In the next definition, things are a little different:

Definition 2. A logic is paraconsistent iff there are some sentences A, B such that ⊢ A and ⊢ ¬A, but not ⊢ B.

A logic that is paraconsistent in the sense of definition 2 automatically satisfies definition 1. But the second definition suggests that there are actually inconsistent theories. The idea is that, in order for explosion to fail, one needs to envisage circumstances in which contradictions obtain. The difference between the definitions is subtle, but it will help us distinguish between two main gradations of paraconsistency, weak and strong.

Roughly, weak paraconsistency is the cluster concept that

  • any apparent contradictions are always due to human error;
  • classical logic is preferable, and in a better world where humans did not err, we would use classical logic;
  • no true theory would ever contain an inconsistency.

Weak paraconsistent logicians see their role as akin to doctors or mechanics. Sometimes information systems develop regrettable but inevitable errors, and paraconsistent logics are tools for damage control. Weak paraconsistentists look for ways to restore consistency to the system or to make the system work as consistently as possible. Weak paraconsistentists have the same view, more or less, of contradictions as do classical logicians.

On the other side, strong paraconsistency includes ideas like

  • Some contradictions may not be errors;
  • classical logic is wrong in principle;
  • some true theories may actually be inconsistent.

A strong paraconsistentist considers relaxing the law of non-contradiction in some way, either by dropping it entirely, so that ¬(A & ¬A) is not a theorem, or by holding that the law can itself figure into contradictions, of the form

Always, not (A and not A),
and sometimes, both A and not A.

Strong paraconsistentists may be interested in inconsistent systems for their own sake, rather like a mathematician considering different non-Euclidean systems of geometry, without worry about the ‘truth’ of the systems; or a strong paraconsistentist may expect that inconsistent systems are true and accurate descriptions of the world, like a physicist considering a non-Euclidean geometry as the actual geometry of space.

It is important to keep weak paraconsistency distinct from logical pluralism, and strong paraconsistency or dialetheism (see §3f.) distinct from logical monism. For example, one can well be a weak paraconsistentist, insofar as one claims that explosion is invalid, even though there are no true contradictions, and at the same time a logical monist, holding that the One True Logic is paraconsistent. This was the position of the fathers of relevance logic, Anderson and Belnap, for instance. Similarly, one could be a dialetheist and a logical pluralist, as is the contemporary philosophical logician Jc Beall (see suggested readings).

c. Requirements for a Logic to be Paraconsistent

All approaches to paraconsistency seek inference relations that do not explode. Sometimes this is accomplished by going back to basics, developing new and powerful ideas about the meaning of logical consequence, and checking that these ideas naturally do not lead to explosion (e.g. relevance logic, §3d). More often paraconsistency is accomplished by looking at what causes explosion in classical inference, and simply removing the causes. In either case, there are some key constraints on a paraconsistent logic that we should look at up front.

Of course, the main requirement is to block the rule of explosion. This is not really a limitation, since explosion is prima facie invalid anyway. But we cannot simply remove the inference of explosion from classical logic and automatically get a paraconsistent logic. The reason for this, and the main, serious constraint on a paraconsistent logic, was discovered by C. I. Lewis in the 1950s. Suppose we have both A and ¬A as premises. If we have A, then we have that either A or B, since a disjunction only requires that one of its disjuncts holds. But then, given ¬A, it seems that we have B, since if either A or B, but not A, then B. Therefore, from A and ¬A, we have deduced B. The problem is that B is completely arbitrary—an absurdity. So if it is invalid to infer everything from a contradiction, then this rule, called disjunctive syllogism,

A ∨ B, ¬A ⊢ B,

must be invalid, too.

There are two things to remark about the failure of disjunctive syllogism (DS).

First, we might say that classical logic runs into trouble when it comes to inconsistent situations. This something like the way Newtonian physics makes bad predictions when it comes to the large-scale structure of space-time. And so similarly, as Newtonian physics is still basically accurate and applicable on medium-sized domains, we can say that classical logic is still accurate and appropriate in consistent domains. For working out sudoku puzzles, paying taxes, or solving murder mysteries, there is nothing wrong with classical reasoning. For exotic objects like contradictions, though, classical logic in unprepared.

Secondly, since DS is a valid classical inference, we can see clearly that a paraconsistent logic will validate fewer inferences than classical logic. (No classically invalid inferences are going to become valid by dint of inconsistent information.) That is the whole idea—that classical logic allows too much, and especially given the possibility of inconsistency, we must be more discriminating. This is sometimes expressed by saying that paraconsistent logics are ‘weaker’ than classical logic; but since paraconsistent logics are more flexible and apply to more situations, we needn’t focus too much on the slang. Classical logic is in many ways more limited than paraconsistent logic (see §4c.).

A third point, which we will take up in §3d, is that the invalidity of DS shows, essentially, that for the basic inference of modus ponens to be valid in all situations, we need a new logical connective for implication, not defined in terms of disjunction and negation. Now we turn to some weak and strong systems of paraconsistency.

3. Schools of Paraconsistent Logic

a. Discussive Logic

The first paraconsistent logic was developed by Jaśkowski, a student of Lukasiewicz, in Poland in 1948. He gave some basic criteria for a paraconsistent logic:

To find a system of sentential calculus which:
1) when applied to contradictory systems would not entail their triviality;
2) would be rich enough to enable practical inference;
3) would have intuitive justification.

To meet his own criteria, Jaśkowski’s idea is to imagine a group of people having a discussion, some of whom are disagreeing with each other. One person asserts: ‘Wealth should be distributed equally amongst all persons.’ Another person says, ‘No, it should not; everyone should just have what he earns.’ The group as a whole is now in an inconsistent information state. We face such states all time time: reading news articles, blogs, and opinion pieces, we take in contradictions (even if each article is internally consistent, which is unusual). How to reason about conflicting information like this?

Jaśkowski’s idea is to prevent the inconsistent information from co-mingling. He does so, in effect, by blocking the rule of adjunction:

A, B ⊢ A & B.

This rule says that, given two premises A and B, we can conjoin them into a single statement, (A & B). If the adjunction rule is removed, then we can have A and ¬A, without deriving a full-blown contradiction A & ¬A. The information is kept separate. On this approach, the classical rule of explosion actually can still hold, in the form

A & ¬A ⊢ B.

The aim of this approach is not to prevent explosion at the sentence level, but rather to ensure that no contradictory sentence (as opposed to inconsistent sentences) can ever arise. So while the inconsistency arising from different disagreeing parties can be made coherent sense of, a person who is internally contradictory is still reckoned to be absurd.

In 1974, Rescher and Brandom suggested a very similar approach, in terms of worlds. As Belnap has pointed out, the non-adjunctive idea has obvious applications to computer science, for example when a large amount of polling data is stored by a system.

b. Preservationism

Around 1978, the Candadian logicians Schotch and Jennings developed an approach to modal logic and paraconsistency that has some close affinities with the discussion approach. Their approach is now known as the preservationist school. The fundamental idea is that, given an inconsistent collection of premises, we should not try to reason about the collection of premises as a whole, but rather focus on internally consistent subsets of premises. Like discussion logics, preservationists see an important distinction between an inconsistent data set, like

{A, ¬A},

which is considered tractable, versus an outright contradiction like

A & ¬A,

which is considered hopeless. The whole idea is summarized in a paraphrase of Gillman Payette, a major contributor to the preservationist program:

Question: How do you reason from an inconsistent set of premises?
Answer: You don’t, since every formula follows in that case. You reason from consistent subsets of premises.

Preservationists begin with an already defined logic X, usually classical logic. They assert that we, as fallible humans, are simply sometimes ‘stuck with bad data’; and this being the case, some kind of repair is needed on the logic X to insure coherence. Preservationists define the level of a set of premises to be the least number of cells into which the set must be divided for every cell to be internally consistent. They then define an inference relation, called forcing, in terms of the logic X, as follows:

A set of sentences Γ forces A iff there is at least one subset Δ of Γ such that A is an X-valid inference from Δ.

Forcing preserves the level of Γ. If there is any consistency to preserve, forcing ensures that things do not get any more inconsistent. In particular, if a data set is inconsistent but contains no single-sentence contradictions, then the forcing relation is paraconsistent.

Aside from paraconsistent applications, and roots in modal logic, preservationists have recently proved some deep theorems about logic more generally. Payette has shown, for example, that two logics are identical iff they assign any set of sentences the same level.

Detour: Chunk and Permeate

Closely related to the preservationist paradigm is a technique called chunk and permeate, developed by Bryson Brown and Graham Priest to explain the early differential calculus of Newton and Leibniz (see inconsistent mathematics). It is known that the early calculus involved contradictions of some kind, in particular, infinitesimal numbers that are sometimes identical to zero, and other times of a non-zero quantity. Brown and Priest show how reasoning about infinitesimals (and their related notions of derivatives) can be done coherently, by breaking up the reasoning into consistent ‘chunks,’ and defining carefully controlled ‘permeations’ between the chunks. The permeations show how enough but not too much information can pass from one chunk to another, and thus reconstruct how a correct mathematical solution can obtain from apparently inconsistent data.

c. Adaptive Logic

Taking applied examples from scientific reasoning as its starting point, the adaptive logic program considers systems in which the rules of inference themselves can change as we go along. The logics are dynamic. In dynamic logics, rules of inference change as a function of what has been derived to that point, and so some sentences which were derivable at a point in time are no longer derivable, and vice versa. The program has been developed by Dederik Batens and his school in Ghent.

The idea is that our commitments may entail a belief that we nevertheless reject. This is because, as humans, our knowledge is not closed under logical consequence and so we are not fully aware of all the consequences of our commitments. When we find ourselves confronted with a problem, there may be two kinds of dynamics at work. In external dynamics, a conclusion may be withdrawn given some new information; logics in which this is allowed are called non-monotonic. External dynamics are widely recognized and are also important to the preservationist program. In internal dynamics, the premises themselves may lead to a conclusion being withdrawn. This kind of dynamic is less recognized and is more properly within the ambit of paraconsistency. Sometimes, we do derive a consequence we later reject, without modifying our convictions.

Adaptive systems work by recognizing abnormalities, and deploying formal strategies. Both of these notions are defined specifically to the task at hand; for instance, an abnormality might be an inconsistency, or it might be an inductive inference, and a strategy might be to delete a line of a proof, or to change an inference rule. The base paraconsistent logic studied by the adaptive school is called CLuN, which is all of the positive (negation-free) fragment of classical logic, plus the law of excluded middle A ∨ ¬A.

d. Relevance

Relevant logic is not fundamentally about issues of consistency and contradiction. Instead the chief motivation of relevant logic is that, for an argument to be valid, the premises must have a meaningful connection to the conclusion. For example, classical inferences like

B ⊢ A ⊃ B,

or

¬(A ⊃ B) ⊢ A,

seem to relevance logicians to fail as decent logical inferences. The requirement that premises be relevant to the conclusion delivers a paraconsistent inference relation as a byproduct, since in ex contradictione quodlibet, the premises A and ¬A do not have anything to do with an arbitrary conclusion B. Relevant logic begins with Ackermann, and was properly developed in the work of Anderson and Belnap. Many of the founders of relevant logic, such as Robert Meyer and Richard Routley, have also been directly concerned with paraconsistency.

From our perspective, one of the most important aspects of relevant logic is that it provides an implication connective that obeys modus ponens, even in inconsistent situations. In §2b, we saw that the disjunctive syllogism is not paraconsistently valid; and so in any logic in which implication is defined by negation and disjunction, modus ponens is invalid, too. That is,

A ⊃ B := ¬A ∨ B

does not, as we saw in §2b above, define a conditional that obeys

A, A ⊃ B ⊢ B.

In the argot, we say that ‘hook is not detachable’ or ‘ponenable’. In relevant logic, implication A → B is not defined with truth-functional connectives at all, but rather is defined either axiomatically or semantically (with worlds or algebraic semantics). Going this way, one can have a very robust implication connective, in which not only modus ponens is valid,

A → B, A; therefore, B.

Other widely used inferences obtain, too. Let’s just mention a few that involve negation in ways that might seem suspect from a paraconsistent point of view. We can have contraposition

A → B ⊢ ¬B → ¬A,

which gives us modus tollens

A → B, ¬B ⊢ ¬A.

With the law of non-contradiction ¬(A & ¬A), this gives us reductio ad absurdum, in two forms,

A → (B & ¬B) ⊢ ¬A,

A → ¬A ⊢ ¬A,

and consequentia mirabilis:

¬A → A ⊢ A.

Evidently the relevant arrow restores a lot of power apparently lost in the invalidity of disjunctive syllogism.

There are a great number of relevant logics differing in strength. One can do away with the laws of non-contradiction and excluded middle, giving a very weak consistent paraconsistent logic called B (for basic). Or one can add powerful negation principles as we have just seen above for inconsistent but non-trivial logics. The relevant approach was used in Meyer’s attempt to found a paraconsistent arithmetic in a logic called R# (see inconsistent mathematics). It has also been used by Brady for naïve set theory (§4c), and, more recently, Beall for truth theory. On the other hand, relevant logics validate fewer entailments than classical logic; in order for A → B to be valid, we have additional requirements of relevance besides truth preservation in all possible circumstances. Because of this, it is often difficult to recapture within a relevant logic some of classical mathematical reasoning. We return to this problem in §4c below.

e. Logics of Formal Inconsistency

One of the first pioneers of paraconsistent logic was Newton C. A. da Costa in Brazil, in the 1950s. Da Costa’s interests have been largely in paraconsistent mathematics (with applications to physics), and his attitude toward paraconsistency is more open minded than some of the others we have seen. Da Costa considers the investigation of inconsistent but not trivial theories as akin to the study of non-Euclidean geometry. He has been an advocate of paraconsistency not only for its pragmatic benefits, for example in reconstructing infinitesimal calculus, but also as an investigation of novel structure for its own sake. He gives the following methodological guidelines:

  • In these calculi, the principle of contradiction should not be generally valid;
  • From two contradictory statements it should not in general be possible to deduce any statement whatever;
  • The extension of these calculi to quantification calculi should be immediate.

Note that da Costa’s first principle is not like any we’ve seen so far, and his third is more ambitious than others. His main system is an infinite hierarchy of logics known as the C systems.

The main idea of the C systems is to track which sentences are consistent and to treat these differently than sentences that may be inconsistent. Following this method, first of all, means that the logic itself is about inconsistency. The logic can model how a person can or should reason about inconsistent information. Secondly, this gives us a principled way to make our paraconsistent logic as much like classical logic as possible: When all the sentences are marked as consistent, they can be safely reasoned about in a classical way, for example, using disjunctive syllogism.

To make this work, we begin with a base logic, called C(0). When a sentence A behaves consistently in C(0), we mark it according to this definition:

A0 := ¬(A & ¬A).

Then, a strong kind of negation can be defined:

–A := ¬A & A0.

The logic with these two connectives added to it, we call C(1). In C(1) then we can have inferences like

¬A ∨ B, A, A0 ⊢ B.

And in the same way that we reached C(1), we could go on and define a logic C(2), with an operator A1 = (A0)0, that means something like ‘behaves consistently in C(1)’. The C systems continue up to the first transfinite ordinal, C(ω).

More recently, a broad generalization of the C-systems has been developed by Carnielli, Marcos, and others, called logics of formal inconsistency. Da Costa’s C-systems are a subclass (albeit an important one) of  the much wider family of  the LFIs. The C-systems are precisely the LFIs where consistency can be expressed as a unary operator.

These logics have been used to model some actual mathematics. The axioms of Zermelo–Fraenkel set theory and some postulates about identity (=) can be added to C(1), as can axioms asserting the existence of a universal set and a Russell set. This yields an inconsistent, non-trivial set theory. Arruda and Batens obtained some early results in this set theory. Work in arithmetic, infinitesimal calculus, and model theory has also been carried out by da Costa and his students.

A driving idea of da Costa’s paraconsistency is that the law of non-contradiction ¬(A & ¬A) should not hold at the propositional level. This is, philosophically, how his approach works: ¬(A & ¬A) is not true. Aside from some weak relevant logics, this is a unique feature of the C systems (among paraconsistent logics). In other schools like the discussion and preservationist schools, non-contradiction holds not only at the level of sentences, but as a normative rule; and in the next school we consider, non-contradiction is false, but it is true as well.

f. Dialetheism

The best reason to study paraconsistency, and to use it for developing theories, would be if there were actually contradictions in the world (as opposed to in our beliefs or theories). That is, if it turns out that the best and truest description of the world includes some inconsistency, then paraconsistency is not only required, but is in some sense natural and appropriate. ‘Dialetheism’ is a neologism meaning two-way truth and is the thesis that some sentences are both true and false, at the same time and in the same way. Dialetheism is particularly motivated as a response to the liar paradox and set theoretic antinomies like Russell’s Paradox, and was pioneered by Richard Routley and Graham Priest in Australia in the 1970s. Priest continues to be the best known proponent.

A dialetheic logic is easiest to understand as a many-valued logic. This is not the only way to understand dialetheism, and the logic we are about to consider is not the only logic a dialetheist could use. Dialetheism is not a logic. But here is a simple way to introduce the concept. In addition to the truth-values true and false, sentences can also be both. This third value is a little unusual, maybe, but uncomplicated: if a sentence A is both, then A is true, and A is false, and vice versa. The most straightforward application of a ‘both’ truth-value is Priest’s logic of paradox, or LP. In LP the standard logical connectives have a natural semantics, which can be deduced following the principle that a sentence is designated iff it is at least true—i.e. iff it is true only, or both true and false. If

¬A is true when A is false,

and

¬A is false when A is true,

for example, then

¬A is both iff A is both.

So inconsistent negation is something like a fixed point. An argument is valid in LP iff it is not possible for the conclusion to be completely false but all the premises at least true. That is, suppose we have premises that are all either true or both. If the argument is valid, then the conclusion is also at least true.

In LP, any sentence of the form ¬(A & ¬A) is always true, and also some instances are sometimes false. So the law of non-contradiction is itself a dialetheia—the schema ¬(A & ¬A) is universal but also has counterexamples—and furthermore, dialetheism says of itself that it is both true and false. (The statement ‘there are true contradictions’ is both true—there are some—and false—all contradictions are false.) This may seem odd, but it is appropriate, given dialetheism’s origins in the liar paradox.

LP uses only extensional connectives (and, or, not) and so has no detachable conditional. If one adds to LP a detachable conditional, then, given its semantics, the most natural extension of LP to a logic with an implication connective is the logic called RM3. Unfortunately, this logic is not appropriate for naïve set theory or truth theory (see §4c.ii). If a fourth neutral truth value is added to LP, the logic is weakened to the system of first degree entailment FDE. In FDE, the inference

B ⊢ A ∨ ¬A

is not valid any more than explosion is. This makes some sense, since if the former is invalid by dint of not representing actual reasoning, then the latter should be invalid, too, since the premise does not ‘lead to’ the conclusion. Because of this, FDE has no theorems, of the form ⊢ A, at all.

4. Applications

A paraconsistent logic becomes useful when we are faced with inconsistencies. Motivations for and applications of paraconsistency arise from situations that are plausibly inconsistent—that is, situations in which inconsistency is not merely due to careless mistakes or confusion, but rather inconsistency that is not easily dispelled even upon careful and concentrated reflection. A student making an arithmetic error does not need a paraconsistent logic, but rather more arithmetic tutorials (although see inconsistent mathematics). On the other hand, people in the following situations may turn to a paraconsistent toolkit.

a. Moral Dilemmas

A mother gives birth to identical conjoined twins (in an example due to Helen Bohse). Doctors quickly assess that if the twins are not surgically separated, then neither will survive. However, doctors also know only one of the babies can survive surgery. The babies are completely identical in all respects. It seems morally obligatory to save one of life at the expense of the other. But because there is nothing to help choose which baby, it also seems morally wrong to let one baby die rather than the other. Quite plausibly, this is an intractable moral dilemma with premises of the form we ought to save the baby on the left, and, by symmetrical reasoning about the baby on the right, also we ought not to save the baby on the left. This is not yet technically a contradiction, but unless some logical precautions are taken, it is a tragic situation on the verge of rational disaster.

A moral dilemma takes the form O(A) and O(¬A), that it is obligatory to do A and it is obligatory to do ¬A. In standard deontic logic—a logic of moral obligations—we can argue from a moral dilemma to moral explosion as follows (see Routley and Plumwood 1989). First, obligations ‘aggregate’:

O(A), O(¬A) ⊢ O(A & ¬A).

Next, note that A & ¬A is equivalent to (A & ¬A) & B. (‘Equivalent’ here can mean classically, or in the sense of C. I. Lewis’ strict implication.) Thus

O(A & ¬A) ⊢ O((A & ¬A) & B)

But O((A & ¬A) & B) ⊢ O(B). So we have shown from inconsistent obligations O(A), O(¬A), that O(B), that anything whatsoever is obligatory—in standard, non-paraconsistent systems.

A paraconsistent deontic logic can follow any of the schools we have seen already. A standard paraconsistent solution is to follow the non-adjunctive approach of Jaśkowski and the preservationists. One can block the rule of modal aggregation, so that both O(A), O(¬A) may hold without implying O(A & ¬A).

Alternatively, one could deny that A & ¬A is strictly equivalent to (A & ¬A) & B, by adopting a logic (such as a relevant logic) in which such an equivalence fails. Taking this path, we would then run into the principle of deontic consistency,

O(A) ⊢ P(A),

that if you ought to do A, then it is permissible to do A. (You are not obliged not to do A.) Accordingly, from O(A & ¬A), we get P(A & ¬A). If we had the further axiom that inconsistent actions are not permitted, then we would now have a full blown inconsistency, P(A & ¬A) and ¬P(A & ¬A). If reductio is allowed, then we would also seem to have obligations such that O(A) and ¬O(A). This move calls attention to which obligations are consistent. One could drop deontic consistency, so that A is obligatory without necessarily being permissible. Or one could reason that, however odd inconsistent actions may sound, there is no obvious reason they should be impermissible. The result would be strange but harmless statements of the form P(A & ¬A).

A principle even stronger than deontic consistency is the Kantian dictum that ‘ought implies can,’ where ‘can’ means basic possibility. Kant’s dictum converts moral dilemmas to explicit contradictions. This seems to rule out moral dilemmas, since it is not possible, e.g., both to save and not to save a baby from our conjoined twins example, it is not obligatory to save one of the two babies, appearances to the contrary. So an option for the paraconsistent deontic logician is to deny Kant’s dictum. Perhaps we have unrealizable obligations; indeed, this seems to be the intuition behind moral dilemmas. A consequence of denying Kant’s dictum is that, sometimes, we inevitably do wrong.

Most liberally, one can keep everything and accept that sometimes inconsistent action is possible. For example, if I make a contract with you to break this very contract, then I break the contract if and only if I keep it. By signing, I am eo ipso breaking and not breaking the contract. In general, though, how one could do both A and its negation is a question beyond the scope of logic.

b. Laws, Science, and Revision

Consider a country with the following laws (in an example from Priest 2006, ch. 13):

(1) No non-Caucasian people shall have the right to vote.
(2) All landowners shall have the right to vote.

As it happens, though, Phil is not Caucasian, and owns a small farm. The laws, as they stand, are inconsistent. A judge may see this as a need to impose a further law (e.g. non-Caucasians cannot own land) or revise one of the current laws. In either case, though, the law as it stands needs to be dealt with in a discriminating way. Crucially, the inferential background of the current laws does not seem to permit or entail total anarchy.

Similarly, in science we hold some body of laws as true. It is part of the scientific process that these laws can be revised, updated, or even rejected completely. The process of such progress again requires that contradictions not be met with systemic collapse. At present, it seems extremely likely that different branches of science are inconsistent with one another—or even within the same discipline, as is the case in theoretical physics with relativity and quantum mechanics. Does this situation make science absurd?

c. Closed Theories – Truth and Sets

Conceptual closure means taking a full account of whatever is under study. Suppose, for example, we are studying language. We carry out our study using language. A closed theory would have to account for our study itself; the language of the theory would have to include terms like ‘language’, ‘theory’, ‘true’, and so forth. More expansively, a theory of everything would include the theory itself. Perhaps the simplest way to grasp the nature of a closed theory is through a remark of Wittgenstein, the preface to his Tractatus: ‘In order to draw a limit to thought, one would have to find both sides of the limit thinkable.’ Priest has argued that the problematic of closure can be seen in the philosophies of Kant and Hegel, as well as in earlier Greek and Medieval thought, and continues on in postmodernist philosophies. As was discovered in the 20th century, closed formal theories are highly liable to be inconsistent, because they are extremely conducive to self-reference and diagonalization (see logical paradoxes).

For logicians, the most important of the closed theories, susceptible to self-reference, are of truth and sets. Producing closed theories of truth and sets using paraconsistency is, at least to start with, straightforward. We will look at two paradigm cases, followed by some detail on how they can be pursued.

i. Naïve Axioms

In modern logic we present formal, mathematical descriptions of how sentences are true and false, e.g. (A & B) is true iff A is true and B is true. This itself is a rational statement, presumably governed by some logic and so itself amenable to formal study. To reason about it logically, we would need to study the truth predicate, ‘x is true.’ An analysis of the concept of truth that is almost too-obviously correct is the schema

T(‘A’) iff A.

It seems so obvious—until (even when?) a sentence like

This sentence of the IEP is false,

a liar paradox which leads to a contradiction, falls out the other side. A paraconsistent logic can be used for a theory of truth in which the truth schema is maintained, but where either the derivation of the paradox is blocked (by dropping the law of excluded middle) or else the contradiction is not explosive.

In modern set theory, similarly, we understand mathematical objects as being built out of sets, where each set is itself built out of pre-given sets. The resulting picture is the iterative hierarchy of sets. The problem is that the iterative hierarchy itself is a mathematically definite object, but cannot itself reside on the hierarchy. A closed theory of sets will include objects like this, beginning from an analysis of the concept of set that is almost too-obviously correct: the naïve comprehension schema,

x is a member of {y: A(y)} iff A(x).

A way to understand what naïve comprehension means is to take it as the claim: any collection of objects is a set, which is itself an object. Naïve set theory can be studied, and has been, with paraconsistent logics; see inconsistent mathematics. Contradictions like the existence of a Russell set {y: y is not a member of y} arise but are simply theorems: natural parts of the theory; they do not explode the theory.

ii. Further Logical Restrictions

For both naïve truth theory and naïve set theory, there is an additional and extremely important restriction on the logic. A logic for these schemas cannot validate contraction,

If (if A then (if A then B)), then (if A then B).

This restriction is due to Curry’s paradox, which is a stronger form of the liar paradox. A Curry sentence says

If this sentence is true, then everything is true.

If the Curry sentence, call it C, is put into the truth-schema, then everything follows by the principle of contraction:

1) T(‘C’) iff (if T(‘C’) then everything). [truth schema]
2) If T(‘C’) then (if T(‘C’) then everything). [from 1]
3) If T(‘C’) then everything. [from 2 by contraction]
4) T(‘C’) [modus ponens on 1, 3]
5) Everything. [modus ponens on 3, 4]

Since not everything is true, if the T schema is correct then contraction is invalid. For set theory, analogously, the Curry set is

C = {x: If x is a member of x, then everything is true},

and a similar argument establishes triviality.

As was discovered later by Dunn, Meyer and Routley while studying naïve set theory in relevant logic, the sentence

(A & (A → B)) → B

is a form of contraction too, and so must similarly not be allowed. (Let A be a Curry sentence and B be absurdity.) Calling this sentence (schema) invalid is different than blocking modus ponens, which is an inference, validated by a rule. The above sentence, meanwhile, is just that—a sentence—and we are saying whether or not all its instances are true. If naïve truth and set theories are coherent, instances of this sentence are not always true, even when modus ponens is valid.

The logic LP does not satisfy contraction and so a dialetheic truth or set theory can be embedded in it. Some basic contradictions, like the liar paradox and Russell’s paradox, do obtain, as do a few core operations. Because LP has no conditional, though, one does not get very far. Most other paraconsistent logics cannot handle naïve set theory and naïve truth theory as stated here. A hard problem in (strong) paraconsistency, then, is how to formulate the ‘iff’ in our naïve schemata, and in general how to formulate a suitable conditional. The most promising candidates to date have been relevant logics, though as we have seen there are strict limitations.

d. Learning, Beliefs, and AI

Some work has been done to apply paraconsistency to modeling cognition. The main idea here is that the limitations on machine reasoning as (apparently) dictated by Gödel’s incompleteness theorems no longer hold. What this has to do with cognition per se is a matter of some debate, and so most applications of paraconsistency to epistemology are still rather speculative. See Berto 2009 for a recent introduction to the area.

Tanaka has shown how a paraconsistent reasoning machine revises its beliefs differently than suggested by the more orthodox but highly idealized Alchourrón-Gärdenfors-Makinson theory. That latter prevailing theory of belief revision has it that inconsistent sets of beliefs are impossible. Paraconsistent reasoning machines, meanwhile, are situated reasoners, in sets of beliefs (say, acquired simply via education) that can occasionally be inconsistent. Consistency is just one of the criteria of epistemic adequacy among others—simplicity, unity, explanatory power, etc. If this is right, the notion of recursive learning might be extended, to shed new light on knowledge acquisition, conflict resolution, and pattern recognition. If the mind is able to reason around contradiction without absurdity, then paraconsistent machines may be better able to model the mind.

Paraconsistent logics have been applied by computer scientists in software architecture (though this goes beyond the expertise of the present author). That paraconsistency could have further applications to the theory of computation was explored by Jack Copeland and Richard Sylvan. Copeland has independently argued that there are effective procedures that go beyond the capacity of Turing machines. Sylvan (formerly Routley) further postulated the possibility of dialethic machines, programs capable of computing their own decision functions. In principle, this is a possibility. The non-computability of decision functions, and the unsolvability of the halting problem, are both proved by reductio ad absurdum: if a universal decision procedure were to exist, it would have some contradictions as outputs. Classically, this has been interpreted to mean that there is no such procedure. But, Sylvan suggests, there is more on heaven and Earth than is dreamt of in classical theories of computation.

5. Conclusion

Paraconsistency may be minimally construed as the doctrine that not everything is true, even if some contradictions are. Most paraconsistent logicians subscribe to views on the milder end of the spectrum; most paraconsistent logicians are actually much more conservative than a slur like Quine’s ‘deviant logician’ might suggest. On the other hand, taking paraconsistency seriously means on some level taking inconsistency seriously, something that a classically minded person will not do. It has therefore been thought that, insofar as true inconsistency is an unwelcome thought—mad, bad, and dangerous to know—paraconsistency might be some kind of gateway to darker doctrines. After all, once one has come to rational grips with the idea that inconsistent data may still make sense, what, really, stands in the way of inconsistent data being true? This has been called the slippery slope from weak to strong paraconsistency. Note that the slippery slope, while proposed as an attractive thought by those more inclined to strong paraconsistency, could seem to go even further, away from paraconsistency completely and toward the insane idea of trivialism: that everything really is true. That is, contradictions obtain, but explosion is also still valid. Why not?

No one, paraconsistentist or otherwise, is a trivialist. Nor is paraconsistency an invitation to trivilalism, even if it is a temptation to dialetheism. By analogy, when Hume pointed out that we cannot be certain that the sun will rise tomorrow, no one became seriously concerned about the possibility. But people did begin to wonder about the necessity of the ‘laws of nature’, and no one now can sit as comfortably as before Hume awoke us from our dogmatic slumber. So too with paraconsistent logic. In one sense, paraconsistent logics can do much more than classical logics. But in studying paraconsistency, especially strong paraconsistency closer to the dialetheic end of the spectrum, we see that there are many things logic cannot do. Logic alone cannot tell us what is true or false. Simply writing down the syntactic marking ‘A’ does nothing to show us that A cannot be false, even if A is a theorem. There is no absolute safeguard. Defending consistency, or denying the absurdity of trivialism, is ultimately not the job of logic alone. Affirming coherence and denying absurdity is an act, a job for human beings.

6. References and Further Reading

It’s a little dated, but the ‘bible’ of paraconsistency is still the first big collection on the topic:

  • Priest, G., Routley, R. & Norman, J. eds. (1989). Paraconsistent Logic: Essays on the Inconsistent. Philosophia Verlag.

This covers most of the known systems, including discussive and adaptive logic, with original papers by the founders. It also has extensive histories of paraconsistent logic and philosophy, and a paper by the Routleys on moral dilemmas. For more recent work, see also

  • Batens, D., Mortensen, C., Priest, G., & van Bendegem, J.-P. eds. (2000). Frontiers of Paraconsistent Logic. Kluwer.
  • Berto, F. and Mares, E., Paoli, F., and Tanaka, K. eds. (2013). The Fourth World Congress on Paraconsistency, Springer.

A roundabout philosophical introduction to non-classical logics, including paraconsistency, is in

  • Beall, JC and Restall, Greg (2006). Logical Pluralism. Oxford University Press.

Philosophical introductions to strong paraconsistency:

  • Priest, Graham (2006). In Contradiction: A Study of the Transconsistent. Oxford University Press. Second edition.
  • Priest, Graham (2006). Doubt Truth to be a Liar. Oxford University Press.
  • Berto, Francesco (2007). How to Sell a Contradiction. Studies in Logic vol. 6. College Publications.

More philosophical debate about strong paraconsistency is in the excellent collection

  • Preist, G., Beall, JC and Armour-Garb, B. eds. (2004). The Law of Non-Contradiction. Oxford University Press.

For the technical how-to of paraconsistent logics:

  • Beall, JC and van Frassen, Bas (2003). Possibilities and Paradox: An Introduction to Modal and Many-Valued Logics. Oxford University Press.
  • Gabbay, Dov M. & Günthner, F. eds. (2002). Handbook of Philosophical Logic. Second edition, vol. 6, Kluwer.
  • Priest, Graham (2008). An Introduction to Non-Classical Logic. Cambridge University Press. Second edition.

For a recent introduction to preservationism, see

  • Schotch, P., Brown, B. and Jennings, R. eds. (2009). On Preserving: Essays on Preservationism and Paraconsistent Logic. University of Toronto Press.
  • Brown, Bryson and Priest, Graham (2004). “Chunk and Permeate I: The Infinitesimal Calculus.” Journal of Philosophical Logic 33, pp. 379–88.

Logics of formal inconsistency:

  • W. A. Carnielli and J. Marcos. A taxonomy of C- systems. In Paraconsistency: the Logical Way to the Inconsistent, Lecture Notes in Pure and Applied Mathematics, Vol. 228, pp. 01–94, 2002.
  • W. A. Carnielli, M. E. Coniglio and J. Marcos.  Logics of Formal Inconsistency. In Handbook of Philosophical Logic, vol. 14, pp. 15–107. Eds.: D. Gabbay; F. Guenthner. Springer, 2007.
  • da Costa, Newton C. A. (1974). “On the Theory of Inconsistent Formal Systems.” Notre Dame Journal of Formal Logic 15, pp. 497–510.
  • da Costa, Newton C. A. (2000). Paraconsistent Mathematics. In Batens et al. (2000), pp. 165–180.
  • da Costa, Newton C. A., Krause, Décio & Bueno, Otávio (2007). “Paraconsistent Logics and Paraconsistency.” In Jacquette, D. ed. Philosophy of Logic (Handbook of the Philosophy of Science), North-Holland, pp. 791–912.

Relevant logics:

  • Anderson, A. R. and Belnap, N. D., Jr. (1975). Entailment: The Logic of Relevance and Necessity. Princeton University Press, vol. I.
  • Mares, E. D. (2004). Relevant Logic: A Philosophical Interpretation. Cambridge University Press.

The implications of Gödel’s theorems:

  • Berto, Francesco (2009). There’s Something About Gödel. Wiley-Blackwell.

Belief revision:

  • Tanaka, Koji (2005). “The AGM Theory and Inconsistent Belief Change.” Logique et Analyse 189–92, pp. 113–50.

Artificial Intelligence:

  • Copeland, B. J. and Sylvan, R. (1999). “Beyond the Universal Turing Machine.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 77, pp. 46–66.
  • Sylvan, Richard (2000). Sociative Logics and their Applications. Priest, G. and Hyde, D. eds. Ashgate.

Moral dilemmas:

  • Bohse, Helen (2005). “A Paraconsistent Solution to the Problem of Moral Dilemmas.” South African Journal of Philosophy 24, pp. 77–86.
  • Routley, R. and Plumwood, V. (1989). “Moral Dilemmas and the Logic of Deontic Notions.” In Priest et al. 1989, 653–690.
  • Weber, Zach (2007). “On Paraconsistent Ethics.” South African Journal of Philosophy 26, pp. 239–244.

Other works cited:

  • Colyvan, Mark (2008). “Who’s Afraid of Inconsistent Mathematics?” Protosociology 25, pp. 24–35. Reprinted in G. Preyer and G. Peter eds. Philosophy of Mathematics: Set Theory, Measuring Theories and Nominalism, Frankfurt: Verlag, 2008, pp. 28–39.
  • Hume, David (1740). A Treatise of Human Nature, ed. L. A. Selby-Bigge. Second edition 1978. Oxford: Clarendon Press.

Author Information

Zach Weber
Email: zweber@unimelb.edu.au
University of Melbourne
Australia

Email: z.weber@usyd.edu.au
University of Sydney
Australia