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Alfred North Whitehead (1861—1947)

Alfred North Whitehead was a notable mathematician, logician, educator and philosopher. The staggering complexity of Whitehead’s thought, coupled with the extraordinary literary quality of his writing, have conspired to make Whitehead (in an oft-repeated saying) one of the most-quoted but least-read philosophers in the Western canon. While he is widely recognized for his collaborative work with Bertrand Russell on the Principia Mathematica, he also made highly innovative contributions to philosophy, especially in the area of process metaphysics. Whitehead was an Englishman by birth and a mathematician by formal education. He was highly regarded by his students as a teacher and noted as a conscientious and hard-working administrator. The volume of his mathematical publication was never great, and much of his work has been eclipsed by more contemporary developments in the fields in which he specialized. Yet many of his works continue to stand out as examples of expository clarity without ever sacrificing logical rigor, while his theory of “extensive abstraction” is considered to be foundational in contemporary field of formal spatial relations known as “mereotopology.”

Whitehead’s decades-long focus on the logical and algebraic issues of space and geometry which led to his work on extension, became an integral part of an explosion of profoundly original philosophical work He began publishing even as his career as an academic mathematician was reaching a close. The first wave of these philosophical works included his Enquiry into the Principles of Natural Knowledge, The Concept of Nature, and The Principle of Relativity, published between 1919 and 1922. These books address the philosophies of science and nature, and include an important critique of the problem of measurement raised by Albert Einstein’s general theory of relativity. They also present an alternative theory of space and gravity. Whitehead built his system around an event-based ontology that interpreted time as essentially extensive rather than point-like.

Facing mandatory retirement in England, Whitehead accepted a position at Harvard in 1924, where he continued his philosophical output. His Science and the Modern World offers a careful critique of orthodox scientific materialism and presents his first worked-out version of the related fallacies of “misplaced concreteness” and “simple location.” The first fallacy is the error of treating an abstraction as though it were concretely real. The second is the error of assuming that anything that is real must have a simple spatial location. But the pinnacle of Whitehead’s metaphysical work came with his monumental Process and Reality in 1929 and his Adventures of Ideas in 1933. The first of these books gives a comprehensive and multi-layered categoreal system of internal and external relations that analyzes the logic of becoming an extension within the context of a solution to the problem of the one and the many, while also providing a ground for his philosophy of nature. The second is an outline of a philosophy of history and culture within the framework of his metaphysical scheme.

Biography
Thought and Writings
Influence and Legacy
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources
2. Secondary Sources

1. Biography

Alfred North Whitehead was born on February 15^th, 1861 at Ramsgate in Kent, England, to Alfred and Maria Whitehead. Thought by his parents to be too delicate for the rough and tumble world of the English public school system, young Alfred was initially tutored at home. Ironically, when he was finally placed in public school, Whitehead became both head boy of his house and captain of his school’s rugby team. Whitehead always looked upon his days as a boy as a rather idyllic time. The education he received at home was always congenial to his natural habit of thinking, and he was able to spend long periods of time walking about in English country settings that were rich with history.

While Whitehead always enjoyed the classics, his true strength was with mathematics. Because of both its quality, and the unique opportunity to take the entrance examinations early, Alfred tested for Trinity College, Cambridge, in 1879, a year before he would otherwise have been allowed to enter. Whitehead’s focus was in mathematics, as were those of about half the hopefuls that were taking the competitive exams that year. While not in the very top tier, Whitehead’s exam scores were nevertheless good enough to gain him entrance into Trinity for the school year beginning in 1880, along with a £50 scholarship. While the money was certainly important, the scholarship itself qualified Whitehead for further rewards and considerations, and set him on the path to eventually being elected a Fellow of Trinity.

This happened in 1884, with the completion of his undergraduate work and his high standing in the finals examinations in mathematics for that year. Whitehead’s early career was focused on teaching, and it is known that he taught at Trinity during every term from 1884 to 1910. He traveled to Germany during an off-season at Cambridge (probably 1885), in part to learn more of the work of such German mathematicians as Felix Klein. Whitehead was also an ongoing member of various intellectual groups at Cambridge during this period. But he published nothing of note, and while he was universally praised as a teacher, the youthful Alfred displayed little promise as a researcher.

In 1891, when he was thirty years of age, Whitehead married Evelyn Wade. Evelyn was in every respect the perfect wife and partner for Alfred. While not conventionally intellectual, Evelyn was still an extremely bright woman, fiercely protective of Alfred and his work, and a true home-maker in the finest sense of the term. Although Evelyn herself was never fully accepted into the social structures of Cambridge society, she always ensured that Alfred lived in a comfortable, tastefully appointed home, and saw to it that he had the space and opportunity to entertain fellow scholars and other Cambrians in a fashion that always reflected well upon the mathematician.

It is also in this period that Whitehead began work on his first major publication, his Treatise on Universal Algebra. Perhaps with his new status as a family man, Whitehead felt the need to better establish himself as a Cambridge scholar. The book would ultimately be of minimal influence in the mathematical community. Indeed, the mathematical discipline that goes by that name shares only its name with Whitehead’s work, and is otherwise a very different area of inquiry. Still, the book established Whitehead’s reputation as a scholar of note, and was the basis for his 1903 election as a Fellow of the Royal Society.

It was after the publication of this work that Whitehead began the lengthy collaboration with his student, and ultimately Trinity Fellow, Bertrand Russell, on that monumental work that would become the Principia Mathematica. However, the final stages of this collaboration would not occur within the precincts of Cambridge. By 1910, Whitehead had been at Trinity College for thirty years, and he felt his creativity was being stifled. But it was also in this year that Whitehead’s friend and colleague Andrew Forsyth’s long-time affair with a married woman turned into a public indiscretion. It was expected that Forsyth would lose his Cambridge professorship, but the school took the extra step of withdrawing his Trinity Fellowship as well. Publicly in protest of this extravagant action, Whitehead resigned his own professorship (though not his Fellowship) as well. Privately, it was the excuse he needed to shake up his own life.

At the age of 49 and lacking even the promise of a job, Whitehead moved his family to London, where he was unemployed for the academic year of 1910 – 11. It was Evelyn who borrowed or bullied the money from their acquaintances that kept the family afloat during that time. Alfred finally secured a lectureship at University College, but the position offered no chance of growth or advancement for him. Finally in 1914, the Imperial College of Science and Technology in London appointed him as a professor of applied Mathematics.

It was here that Whitehead’s initial burst of philosophical creativity occurred. His decades of research into logic and spatial reasoning expressed itself in a series of three profoundly original books on the subjects of science, nature, and Einstein’s theory of relativity. At the same time, Whitehead maintained his teaching load while also assuming an increasing number of significant administrative duties. He was universally praised for his skill in all three of these general activities. However, by 1921 Whitehead was sixty years old and facing mandatory retirement within the English academic system. He would only be permitted to work until his sixty-fifth birthday, and then only with an annual dispensation from Imperial College. So it was that in 1924, Whitehead accepted an appointment as a professor of philosophy at Harvard University.

While Whitehead’s work at Imperial College is impressive, the explosion of works that came during his Harvard years is absolutely astounding. These publications include Science and the Modern World, Process and Reality, and Adventures of Ideas.

Whitehead continued to teach at Harvard until his retirement in 1937. He had been elected to the British Academy in 1931, and awarded the Order of Merit in 1945. He died peacefully on December 30^th, 1947. Per the explicit instructions in his will, Evelyn Whitehead burned all of his unpublished papers. This action has been the source of boundless regret for Whitehead scholars, but it was Whitehead’s belief that evaluations of his thought should be based exclusively on his published work.

2. Thought and Writings

a. Major Thematic Structures

The thematic and historical analyses of Whitehead’s work largely coincide. However, these two approaches naturally lend themselves to slightly different emphases, and there are important historical overlaps of the dominating themes of his thought. So it is worthwhile to view these themes ahistorically prior to showing their temporal development.

The first of these thematic structures might reasonably be called “the problem of space.” The confluence of several trends in mathematical research set this problem at the very forefront of Whitehead’s own inquiries. James Clerk Maxwell’s Treatise on electromagnetism had been published in 1873, and Maxwell himself taught at Cambridge from 1871 until his death in 1879. The topic was a major subject of interest at Cambridge, and Whitehead wrote his Trinity Fellowship dissertation on Maxwell’s theory. During the same period, William Clifford in England, and Felix Klein and Wilhelm Killing in Germany were advancing the study of spaces of constant curvature. Whitehead was well aware of their work, as well as that of Hermann Grassmann, whose ideas would later become of central importance in tensor analysis.

The second major trend of Whitehead’s thought can be usefully abbreviated as “the problem of history,” although a more accurate descriptive phrase would be “the problem of the accretion of value.” Of the two themes, this one can be the more difficult to discern within Whitehead’s corpus, partly because it is often implicit and does not lend itself to formalized analysis. In its more obvious forms, this theme first appears in Whitehead’s writings on education. However, even in his earliest works, Whitehead’s concern with the function of symbolism as an instrument in the growth of knowledge shows a concern for the accretion of value. Nevertheless, it is primarily with his later philosophical work that this topic emerges as a central element and primary focus of his thought.

b. The Early Mathematical Works

Whitehead’s first major publication was his A Treatise on Universal Algebra with Applications (“UA,” 1898.) (Whenever appropriate, common abbreviations will be given, along with the year of publication, for Whitehead’s major works.) Originally intended as a two-volume work, the second volume never appeared as Whitehead’s thinking on the subject continued to evolve, and as the plans for Principia Mathematica eventually came to incorporate many of the objectives of this volume. Despite the “algebra” in the title, the work is primarily on the foundations of geometry and formal spatial relations. UA offers little in the way of original research by Whitehead. Rather, the work is primarily expository in character, drawing together a number of previously divergent and scattered themes of mathematical investigation into the nature of spatial relations and their underlying logic, and presenting them in a systematic form.

While the book helped establish Whitehead’s reputation as a scholar and was the basis of his election as a Fellow of the Royal Society, UA had little direct impact on mathematical research either then or later. Part of the problem was the timing and approach of Whitehead’s method. For while he was very explicit about the need for the rigorous development of symbolic logic, Whitehead’s logic was “algebraic” in character. That is to say, Whitehead’s focus was on relational systems of order and structure preserving transformations. In contrast, the approaches of Giuseppe Peano and Gottlob Frege, with their emphasis on proof and semantic relations, soon became the focus of mathematical attention. While these techniques were soon to become of central importance for Whitehead’s own work, the centrality of algebraic methods to Whitehead’s thinking is always in evidence, especially in his philosophy of nature and metaphysics. The emphasis on structural relations in these works is a key component to understanding his arguments.

In addition, UA itself was one in a rising chorus of voices that had begun to take the work of Hermann Grassmann seriously. Grassmann algebras would come to play a vital role in tensor analysis and general relativity. Finally, the opening discussion of UA regarding the importance and uses of formal symbolism remains of philosophical interest, both in its own right and as an important element in Whitehead’s later thought.

Other early works by Whitehead include his two short books, the Axioms of Projective Geometry (1906) and the Axioms of Descriptive Geometry (1907). These works take a much more explicitly logical approach to their subject matter, as opposed to the algebraic techniques of Whitehead’s first book. However, it remains the case that these two works are not about presenting cutting edge research so much as they are about the clear and systematic development of existing materials. As suggested by their titles, the approach is axiomatic, with the axioms chosen for their illustrative and intuitive value, rather than their strictly logical parsimony. As such, these books continue to serve as clear and concise introductions to their subject matters.

Even as he was writing the two Axioms books, Whitehead was well into the collaboration with Bertrand Russell that would lead to the three volumes of the Principia Mathematica. Although most of the Principia was written by Russell, the work itself was a truly collaborative endeavor, as is demonstrated by the extant correspondence between the two. The intention of the Principia was to deduce the whole of arithmetic from absolutely fundamental logical principles. But Whitehead’s role in the project, besides working with Russell on the vast array of details in the first three volumes, was to be the principal author of a fourth volume whose focus would be the logical foundations of geometry. Thus, what Whitehead had originally intended to be the second volume of UA had transformed into the fourth volume of the Principia Mathematica, and like that earlier planned volume, the fourth part of Principia Mathematica never appeared. It would not be until Whitehead’s published work on the theory of extension, work that never appeared independently but always as a part of a larger philosophical enterprise, that his research into the foundations of geometry would finally pay off.

c. Writings on Education

By the time the Principia was published, Whitehead had left his teaching position at Trinity, and eventually secured a lectureship at London’s University College. It was in these London years that Whitehead published a number of essays and addresses on the theory of education. But it would be a mistake to suppose that his concern with education began with the more teaching-oriented (as opposed to research-oriented) positions he occupied after departing Cambridge. Whitehead had long been noted as an exceptional lecturer by his students at Cambridge. He also took on less popular teaching duties, such as teaching at the non-degree conferring women’s institutions associated with Cambridge of Girton and Newham colleges.

Moreover, the concern for the conveyance of ideas is evident from the earliest of Whitehead’s writings. The very opening pages of UA are devoted to a discussion of the reasons and economies of well-chosen symbols as aids to the advancement of thought. Or again, the intention underlying the two Axioms books was not so much the advancement of research as the communication of achieved developments in mathematics. Whitehead’s book, An Introduction to Mathematics (1911), published in the midst of the effort to get the Principia out, had no research agenda per se. This book was again entirely devoted toward introducing students to the character of mathematical thought, to the methods of abstraction, the nature of variables and functions, and to offer some sense of the power and generality of these formalisms.

Whitehead’s essays that specifically address education often do so with the explicit desire to revise the teaching of mathematics in England. But they also argue, both explicitly and implicitly, for a balance of liberal education devoted to the opening of the mind, with technical education intended to facilitate the vocational aptitudes of the student. Education for Whitehead was never just the mere memorization of ancient stories and empty abstractions, any more than it was just the technical training of the working class. It always entailed the growth of the student as a fully functioning human being. In this respect, as well as others, Whitehead’s arguments compare favorably with those of John Dewey.

Whitehead never systematized his educational thought the way Dewey did, so these ideas must be gleaned from his various essays and looked for as an implicit foundation to such larger works as his Adventures of Ideas (see below). Many of Whitehead’s essays on education were collected together in The Aims of Education, published in 1929, as well as his Essays in Science and Philosophy, published in 1948.

d. The Philosophy of Nature

Whitehead’s interest in the problem of space was, at least from his days as a graduate student at Cambridge, more than just an interest in the purely formal or mathematical aspects of geometry. It is to be recalled that his dissertation was on Maxwell’s theory of electromagnetism, which was a major development in the ideas that led to Einstein’s theories of special and general relativity. The famous Michelson-Morely experiment to measure the so-called “Ether drift” was a response to Maxwell’s theory of electromagnetism. Einstein himself offers only a generic nod toward the experiments regarding space and light in his 1905 paper on special relativity. The problem Einstein specifically cites in that paper is the lack of symmetry then to be found in theories of space and the behavior of electromagnetic phenomena. By 1910, when the first volume of the Principia Mathematica was being published, Hermann Minkowski had reorganized the mathematics of Einstein’s special relativity into a four-dimensional non-Euclidean manifold. By 1914, two years before the publication of Einstein’s paper on general relativity, theoretical developments had advanced to the extent that an expedition to the Crimea was planned to observe the predicted bending of stellar light around the sun during an eclipse. This expedition was cancelled with the eruption of the First World War.

These developments helped conspire to prevent Whitehead’s planned fourth volume of the Principia from ever appearing. A few papers appeared during the war years, in which a relational theory of space begins to emerge. What is perhaps most notable about these papers is that they are no longer specifically mathematical in nature, but are explicitly philosophical. Finally, in 1919 and 1920, Whitehead’s thought appeared in print with the publications of two books, An Enquiry into the Principles of Natural Knowledge (“PNK,” 1919) and The Concept of Nature (“CN,” 1920).

While PNK is much more formally technical than CN, both books share a common and radical view of nature and science that rejects the identification of nature with the mathematical tools used to characterize its relational structures. Nature for Whitehead is that which is experienced through the senses. For this reason, Whitehead argues that there are no such things as “points” of either time or space. An infinitesimal point is a high abstraction with no experiential reality, while time and space are irreducibly extensional in character.

To account for the effectiveness of mathematical abstractions in their application to natural knowledge, Whitehead introduced his theory of “extensive abstraction.” By using the logical and topological structures of concentric part-whole relations, Whitehead argued that abstract entities such as geometric points could be derived from the concrete, extensive relations of space and time. These abstract entities, in their turn, could be shown to be significant of the nature they had been abstractively derived from. Moreover, since these abstract entities were formally easier to use, their significance of nature could be retained through their various deductive relations, thereby giving evidence for further natural significances by this detour through purely abstract relations.

Whitehead also rejected “objects” as abstractions, and argued that the fundamental realities of both experience and nature are events. Events are themselves irreducibly extended entities, where the temporal / durational extension is primary. “Objects” are the idealized significances that retain a stable meaning through an event or family of events.

It is important to note here that Whitehead is arguing for a kind of empiricism. But, as Victor Lowe has noted, this empiricism is more akin to the ideas of William James than it is to the logical positivism of Whitehead’s day. In other words, Whitehead is arguing for a kind of Jamesian “radical empiricism,” in which sense-data are abstractions, and the basic deliverances of raw experience include such things as relations and complex events.

These ideas were further developed with the publication of Whitehead’s The Principles of Relativity with Applications to Natural Science (“R,” 1922). Here Whitehead proposed an alternative physical theory of space and gravity to Einstein’s general relativity. Whitehead’s theory has commonly been classified as “quasi-linear” in the physics literature, when it should properly be describes as “bimetric.” Einstein’s theory collapses the physical and the spatial into a single metric, so that gravity and space are essentially identified. Whitehead pointed out that this then loses the logical relations necessary to make meaningful cosmological measurements. In order to make meaningful measurements of space, we must know the geometry of that space so that the congruence relations of our measurement instruments can be projected through that space while retaining their significance. Since Einstein’s theory loses the distinction between the physical and the geometrical, the only way we can know the geometry of the space we are trying to measure is if we first know the distributions of matter and energy throughout the cosmos that affect that geometry. But we can only know these distributions if we can first make accurate measurements of space. Thus, as Whitehead argued, we are left in the position of first having to know everything before we can know anything.

Whitehead argued that the solution to this problem was to separate the necessary relations of geometry from the contingent relations of physics, so that one’s theory of space and gravity is “bimetric,” or is built from the two metrics of geometry and physics. Unfortunately, Whitehead never used the term “bimetric,” and his theory has often been misinterpreted. Questions of the viability of Whitehead’s specific theory have needlessly distracted both philosophers and physicists from the real issue of the class of theories of space and gravity that Whitehead was arguing for. Numerous viable bimetric alternatives to Einstein’s theory of relativity are currently known in the physics literature. But because Whitehead’s theory has been misclassified and its central arguments poorly understood, the connections between Whitehead’s philosophical arguments and these physical theories have largely gone unnoticed.

e. The Metaphysical Works

The problems Whitehead had engaged with his triad of works on the philosophy of nature and science required a complete re-evaluation of the assumptions of modern science. To this end, Whitehead published Science in the Modern World (“SMW,” 1925). This work had both a critical and a constructive aspect, although the critical themes occupied most of Whitehead’s attention. Central to those critical themes was Whitehead’s challenge to dogmatic scientific materialism developed through an analysis of the historical developments and contingencies of that belief. In addition, he continued with the themes of his earlier triad, arguing that objects in general, and matter in particular, are abstractions. What are most real are events and their mutual involvements in relational structures.

Already in PNK, Whitehead had characterized electromagnetic phenomena by saying that while such phenomena could be related to specific vector quantities at each specific point of space, they express “at all points one definite physical fact” (PNK, 29). Physical facts such as electromagnetic phenomena are single, relational wholes, but they are spread out across the cosmos. In SMW Whitehead called the failure to appreciate this holism and the relational connectedness of reality, “the fallacy of simple location.” According to Whitehead, much of contemporary science, driven as it was by the dogma of materialism, was committed to the fallacy that only such things as could be localized at a mathematically simple “point” of space and time were genuinely real. Relations and connections were, in this dogmatic view, secondary to and parasitic upon such simply located entities. Whitehead saw this as reversing the facts of nature and experience, and devoted considerable space in SMW to criticizing it.

A second and related fallacy of contemporary science was what Whitehead identified in SMW as, “the fallacy of misplaced concreteness.” While misplaced concreteness could include treating entities with a simple location as more real than those of a field of relations, it also went beyond this. Misplaced concreteness included treating “points” of space or time as more real than the extensional relations that are the genuine deliverances of experience. Thus, this fallacy resulted in treating abstractions as though they were concretely real. In Whitehead’s view, all of contemporary physics was infected by this fallacy, and the resultant philosophy of nature had reversed the roles of the concrete and the abstract.

The critical aspects of SMW were ideas that Whitehead had already expressed (in different forms) in his previous publications, only now with more refined clarity and persuasiveness. On the other hand, the constructive arguments in SMW are astonishing in their scope and subtlety, and are the first presentation of his mature metaphysical thinking. For example, the word “prehension,” which Whitehead defines as “uncognitive apprehension” (SMW 69) makes its first systematic appearance in Whitehead’s writings as he refines and develops the kinds and layers of relational connections between people and the surrounding world. As the “uncognitive” in the above is intended to show, these relations are not always or exclusively knowledge based, yet they are a form of “grasping” of aspects of the world. Our connection to the world begins with a “pre-epistemic” prehension of it, from which the process of abstraction is able to distill valid knowledge of the world. But that knowledge is abstract and only significant of the world; it does not stand in any simple one-to-one relation with the world. In particular, this pre-epistemic grasp of the world is the source of our quasi- a priori knowledge of space which enables us to know of those uniformities that make cosmological measurements, and the general conduct of science, possible.

SMW goes far beyond the purely epistemic program of Whitehead’s philosophy of nature. The final three chapters, entitled “God,” “Religion and Science,” and “Requisites for Social Progress,” clearly announce the explicit emergence of the second major thematic strand of Whitehead’s thought, the “problem of history” or “the accretion of value.” Moreover, these topics are engaged with the same thoroughly relational approach that Whitehead previously used with nature and science.

Despite the foreshadowing of these last chapters of SMW, Whitehead’s next book may well have come as a surprise to his academic colleagues. Whitehead’s brief Religion in the Making (“RM,” 1926) tackles no part of his earlier thematic problem of space, but instead focuses entirely on the second thematic of history and value. Whitehead defines religion as “what the individual does with his own solitariness” (RM 16). Yet it is still Whitehead the algebraist who is constructing this definition. Solitariness is understood as a multi-layered relational modality of the individual in and toward the world. In addition, this relational mode cannot be understood in separation from its history. On this point, Whitehead compares religion with arithmetic. Thus, an understanding of the latter makes no essential reference to its history, whereas for religion such a reference is vital. Moreover, as Whitehead states, “You use arithmetic, but you are religious” (RM 15).

Whitehead also argues that, “The purpose of God is the attainment of value in the temporal world,” and “Value is inherent in actuality itself” (RM 100). Whitehead’s use of the word “God” in the foregoing invites a wide range of habitual assumptions about his meaning, most, if not all, of which will probably be mistaken. The key element for Whitehead is value. God, like arithmetic, is discussed in terms of something which has a purpose. On the other hand, value is like being religious in that it is inherent. It is something that is rather than something that is used.

Shortly after this work, there appeared another book whose brevity betrays its importance, Symbolism its Meaning and Effect (“S,” 1927). Whitehead’s explicit interest in symbols was present in his earliest publication. But in conjunction with his theory of prehension, the theory of symbols came to take on an even greater importance for him. Our “uncognitive” sense-perceptions are directly caught up in our symbolic awareness as is shown by the immediacy with which we move beyond what is directly given to our senses. Whitehead uses the example of a puppy dog that sees a chair as a chair rather than as a patch of color, even though the latter is all that impinges on the dog’s retina. (Whitehead may not have known that dogs are color blind, but this does not significantly affect his example.) Thus, this work further develops Whitehead’s theories of perception and awareness, and does so in a manner that is relatively non-technical. Because of the centrality of the theory of symbols and perception to Whitehead’s later philosophy, this clarity of exposition makes this book a vital stepping stone to what followed.

What followed was Process and Reality (“PR,” 1929). This book is easily one of the most dense and difficult works in the entire Western canon. The book is rife with technical terms of Whitehead’s own invention, necessitated by his struggle to push beyond the inherited limits of the available concepts toward a comprehensive vision of the logical structures of becoming. It is here that we see the problem of space receive its ultimate payoff in Whitehead’s thought. But this payoff comes in the form of a fully relational metaphysical scheme that draws upon his theory of symbols and perception in the most essential manner possible. At the same time, PR plants the seeds for the further engagement of the problem of the accretion of value that is to come in his later work. Because each process of becoming must be considered holistically as an essentially organic unity, Whitehead often refers to his theory as the “philosophy of organism.”

PR invites controversy while defying brief exposition. Many of the relational ideas Whitehead develops are holistic in character, and thus do not lend themselves to the linear presentation of language. Moreover, the language Whitehead needs to build his holistic image of the world is often biological or mentalistic in character, which can be jarring when the topic being discussed is something like an electron. Moreover, Whitehead the algebraist was an intrinsically relational thinker, and explicitly characterized the subject / predicate mode of language as a “high abstraction.” Nevertheless, there are some basic ideas which can be quickly set out.

The first of these is that PR is not about time per se. This has been a subject of much confusion. But Whitehead himself points out that physical time as such only comes about with “reflection” of the “divisibility” of his two major relational types into one another (PR 288 – 9). Moreover, throughout PR, Whitehead continues to endorse the theory of nature found in his earlier triad of books on the subject. So the first step in gaining a handle on PR is to recognize that it is better thought of as addressing the logic of becoming, whereas his books from 1919 – 1922 address the “nature” of time.

The basic units of becoming for Whitehead are “actual occasions.” Actual occasions are “drops of experience,” and relate to the world into which they are emerging by “feeling” that relatedness and translating it into the occasion’s concrete reality. When first encountered, this mode of expression is likely to seem peculiar if not downright outrageous. One thing to note here is that Whitehead is not talking about any sort of high-level cognition. When he speaks of “feeling” he means an immediacy of concrete relatedness that is vastly different from any sort of “knowing,” yet which exists on a relational spectrum where cognitive modes can emerge from sufficiently complex collections of occasions that interrelate within a systematic whole. Also, feeling is a far more basic form of relatedness than can be represented by formal algebraic or geometrical schemata. These latter are intrinsically abstract, and to take them as basic would be to commit the fallacy of misplaced concreteness. But feeling is not abstract. Rather, it is the first and most concrete manifestation of an occasion’s relational engagement with reality.

This focus on concrete modes of relatedness is essential because an actual occasion is itself a coming into being of the concrete. The nature of this “concrescence,” using Whitehead’s term, is a matter of the occasion’s creatively internalizing its relatedness to the rest of the world by feeling that world, and in turn uniquely expressing its concreteness through its extensive connectedness with that world. Thus an electron in a field of forces “feels” the electrical charges acting upon it, and translates this “experience” into its own electronic modes of concreteness. Only later do we schematize these relations with the abstract algebraic and geometrical forms of physical science. For the electron, the interaction is irreducibly concrete.

Actual occasions are fundamentally atomic in character, which leads to the next interpretive difficulty. In his previous works, events were essentially extended and continuous. And when Whitehead speaks of an “event” in PR without any other qualifying adjectives, he still means the extensive variety found in his earlier works (PR 73). But PR deals with a different set of problems from that previous triad, and it cannot take such continuity for granted. For one thing, Whitehead treats Zeno’s Paradoxes very seriously and argues that one cannot resolve these paradoxes if one starts from the assumption of continuity, because it is then impossible to make sense of anything coming immediately before or immediately after anything else. Between any two points of a continuum such as the real number line there are an infinite number of other points, thus rendering the concept of the “next” point meaningless. But it is precisely this concept of the “next occasion” that Whitehead requires to render intelligible the relational structures of his metaphysics. If there are infinitely many occasions between any two occasions, even ones that are nominally “close” together, then it becomes impossible to say how it is that later occasions feel their predecessors – there is an unbounded infinity of other occasions intervening in such influences, and changing it in what are now undeterminable ways. Therefore, Whitehead argued, continuity is not something which is “given;” rather it is something which is achieved. Each occasion makes itself continuous with its past in the manner in which it feels that past and creatively incorporates the past into its own concrescence, its coming into being.

Thus, Whitehead argues against the “continuity of becoming” and in favor of the “becoming of continuity” (PR 68 – 9). Occasions become atomically, but once they have become they incorporate themselves into the continuity of the universe by feeling the concreteness of what has come before and making that concreteness a part of the occasion’s own internal makeup. The continuity of space and durations in Whitehead’s earlier triad does not conflict with his metaphysical atomism, because those earlier works were dealing with physical nature in which continuity has already come into being, while PR is dealing with relational structures that are logically and metaphysically prior to nature.

Most authors believe that the sense of “atomic” being used here is similar to, if not synonymous with, “microscopic.” However, there are reasons why one might want to resist such an interpretation. To begin with, it teeters on the edge of the fallacy of simple location to assume that by “atomic” Whitehead means “very small.” An electron, which Whitehead often refers to as an “electronic occasion,” may have a tiny region of most highly focused effects. But the electromagnetic field that spreads out from that electron reaches far beyond that narrow focus. The electron “feels” and is “felt” throughout this field of influence which is not spatially limited. Moreover, Whitehead clearly states that space and time are derivative notions from extension whereas, “To be an actual occasion in the physical world means that the entity in question is a relatum in this scheme of extensive connection” (PR 288 – 9). The quality of being microscopic is something that only emerges after one has a fully developed notion of space, while actual occasions are logically prior to space and a part of the extensive relations from which space itself is derived. Thus it is at least arguably the case that the sense of “atomic” that Whitehead is employing hearkens back more to the original Greek meaning of “irreducible” than to the microscopic sense that pervades physical science. In other words, the “atomic” nature of what is actual is directly connected to its relational holism.

The structure of PR is also worth attention, for each of the five major parts offers a significant perspective on the whole. Part I gives Whitehead’s defense of speculative philosophy and sets out the “categoreal scheme” underlying PR. The second part applies these categories to a variety of historical and thematic topics. Part three gives the theory of prehensions as these manifest themselves with and through the categories, and is often called the “genetic account.” The theory of extension, or the “coordinate account,” constitutes part four and represents the ultimate development of Whitehead’s rigorous thought on the nature of space. The last and final part presents both a theory of the dialectic of opposites, and the minimalist role of God in Whitehead’s system as the foundation of coherence in the world’s processes of becoming.

Two of the features of part I that stand out are Whitehead’s defense of speculative philosophy, and his proposed resolution of the traditional problem of the One and the Many. “Speculative philosophy” for Whitehead is a phrase he uses interchangeably with “metaphysics.” However, what Whitehead means is a speculative program in the most scientifically honorific sense of the term. Rejecting any form of dogmatism, Whitehead states that his purpose is to, “frame a coherent, logical, necessary system of general ideas in terms of which every element of our experience can be interpreted” (PR 3). The second feature, the solution to the problem of the “one and the many,” is often summarized as, “The many become one, and increase by one.” This means that the many occasions of the universe that have already become contribute their atomic reality to the becoming of a new occasion (“the many become one”). However, this occasion, upon fully realizing in its own atomic character, now contributes that reality to the previously achieved realities of the other occasions (“and increase by one”).

The atomic becoming of an actual occasion is achieved by that occasion’s “prehensive” relations and its “extensive” relations. An actual occasion’s holistically felt and non-sequentially internalized concrete evaluations of its relationships to the rest of the world is the subject matter of the theory of “prehension,” part III of PR. This is easily one of the most difficult and complex portions of that work. The development that Whitehead is describing is so holistic and anti-sequential that it might appropriately be compared to James Joyce’s Finnegan’s Wake. An actual occasion “prehends” its world (relationally takes that world in) by feeling the “objective data” of past occasions which the new occasion utilizes in its own concrescence. This data is prehended in an atemporal and nonlinear manner, and is creatively combined into the occasion’s own manifest self-realization. This is to say that the becoming of the occasion is also informed by a densely teleological sense of the occasion’s own ultimate actuality, its “subjective aim” or what Whitehead calls the occasion’s “superject.” Once it has become fully actualized, the occasion as superject becomes an objective datum for those occasions which follow it, and the process begins again.

This same process of concrescence is described in its extensive characters in part IV, where the mereological (formal relations of part and whole) as well as topological (non-metrical relations of neighborhood and connection) characteristics of extension are developed. Unlike the subtle discussion of prehensions, Whitehead’s theory of extension reads very much like a text book on the logic of spatial relations. Indeed, a great deal of contemporary work in artificial intelligence and spatial reasoning identifies this section of PR as foundational to this field of research, which often goes by the intimidating title of “mereotopology.”

The holistic character of prehension and the analytical nature of extension invite the reader to interpret the former as a theory of “internal relations” and the latter as a theory of “external relations.” Put simply, external relations treat the self-identity of a thing as the first, analytically given fact, while internal relations treat it as the final, synthetically developed result. But Whitehead explicitly associates internal relations with extension, and externality with that of prehension. This seeming paradox can be resolved by noting that, even though prehension is the process of the actual occasion’s “internalizing” the rest of reality as it composes its own self-identity, the achieved result (the superject) is the atomic realization of that occasion in its ultimate externality to the rest of the world. On the other hand, the mereological relations of part and whole from which extension is built, are themselves so intrinsically correlative to one another that each only meaningfully expresses its own relational structures to the extent that it completely internalizes the other.

Whitehead was never one to revisit a problem once he felt he had addressed it adequately. With the publication of PR and the final version of his theory of extension, Whitehead never returned to the ‘problem of space’ except on those limited occasions when his later work required that he mention those earlier developments. Those later works were effectively focused upon the ‘problem of history’ to the exclusion of all else. The primary book on this topic is Adventures of Ideas (“AI,” 1933).

AI is a pithy and engaging book whose opening pages entice the reader with clear and evidently non-technical language. But it is a book that needs to be approached with care. Whitehead assumes, without explanation, knowledge on the part of his readers of the metaphysical scheme of PR, and resorts to the terminology of that book whenever the argument requires it. Indeed, AI is the application of Whitehead’s process metaphysics to the “problem of history.” Whitehead surveys numerous cultural forms from a thoroughly relational perspective, analyzing the ways in which these connections contribute both to the rigidities of culture and the possibilities for novelty in various “adventures” in the accumulation of meanings and values. Many of the forces in this adventure of meaning are blind and senseless, thus presenting the challenge of becoming more deliberate in our processes of building and changing them.

In line with this, two other works bear mentioning: The Function of Reason (“FR,” 1929) and Modes of Thought (“MT,” 1938). FR presents an updated version of Aristotle’s three classes of soul (the vegetative, the animate, and the rational); only in Whitehead’s case, the classifications are, as the title states, functional rather than facultative. Thus, for Whitehead, the function of reason is “promote the art of life,” which is a three-fold function of “(i) to live, (ii) to live well, (iii) to live better” (FR 4, 8). Thus, reason for Whitehead is intrinsically organic in both origin and purpose. But the achievement of a truly reasonable life is a matter that involves more than just the logical organization of propositional knowledge. It is a matter of full and sensitive engagement with the entire lived world. This is the topic of MT, Whitehead’s final major publication. In arguing for a multiplicity of modes of thought, Whitehead offered his final great rebellion against the excessive focus on language that dominated the philosophical thought of his day. In this work, Whitehead also offered his final insight as to the purpose and function of philosophy itself. “The use of philosophy,” Whitehead concluded, “is to maintain an active novelty of fundamental ideas illuminating the social system. It reverses the slow descent of accepted thought towards the inactive commonplace.” In this respect, “philosophy is akin to poetry” (MT 174).

3. Influence and Legacy

Evaluating Whitehead’s influence is a difficult matter. While Whitehead’s influence has never been great, in the opening years of the 21^st century it appears to be growing in a broad range of otherwise divergent disciplines. Fulfilling his own vision of the use of philosophy, Whitehead’s ideas are a rich trove of alternative approaches to traditional problems. His thoroughgoing relational and process orientation offers numerous opportunities to reimagine the ways in which the world is connected and how those connections manifest themselves.

The most prominent area of ongoing Whiteheadian influence is within process theology. While Whitehead’s explicit philosophical treatments of God seldom went beyond that of an ideal principle of maximal coherence, many others have developed these ideas further. Writers such as Charles Hartshorne and John Cobb have speculated on, and argued for, a much more robust, ontological conception of God. Nothing in Whitehead’s own writings require such developments, but neither are they in any way precluded. The God of process theology tends to be far more personal and much more of a co-participant in the creative process of the universe than that which one often finds in orthodox religions.

Within philosophy itself, Whitehead’s influence has been smaller and much more diffuse. Yet those influences are likely to crop up in what seem, on the surface at least, to be improbable places. The literature here is too vast to enumerate, but it includes researches from all of the major philosophical schools including pragmatism, analytical, and continental thought. The topics engaged include ontology, phenomenology, personalism, philosophical anthropology, ethics, political theory, economics, etc.

There are also a variety of ways in which Whitehead’s work continues to influence scientific research. This influence is, again, typically found only in the work of widely scattered individuals. However, one area where this is not the case is Whitehead’s theory of extension. Whitehead’s work on the logical basis of geometry is widely cited as foundational in the study of mereotopology, which in turn is of fundamental importance in the study of spatial reasoning, especially in the context of artificial intelligence.

There is also a growing interest in Whitehead’s work within physics, where it is proving to be a valuable source of ideas to help re-conceive the nature of physical relations. This is particularly true of such bizarre phenomena as quantum entanglement, which seems to violate orthodox notions of mechanistic interaction. There is a renewed interest in Whitehead’s arguments regarding relativity, particularly because of their potential tie-in with other bimetric theories of space and gravity. Other areas of interest include biology, where Whitehead’s holistic relationalism again offers alternative models of explanation.

4. References and Further Reading

Those of Whitehead’s primary texts which have been mentioned in the article are listed below in chronological order. More technical works have been “starred” with an asterisk. Original publication dates are given, as well as more recent printings. Of these more recent printings, those done by Dover Publications have been favored because they retain the pagination of the original imprints. On the other hand, the volume of the secondary literature on Whitehead is truly astounding, and a comprehensive list would go far beyond the limits of this article. So while the secondary works listed below can hardly be viewed as definitive, they do offer a useful starting place. The secondary sources are divided into two groups, those that are relatively more accessible and those that are relatively more technical.

a. Primary Sources

*A Treatise on Universal Algebra (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1898.)
*The Axioms of Projective Geometry (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1906.)
*The Axioms of Descriptive Geometry, (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1907. Mineaola: Dover Phoenix Editions, 2005.)
- The two Axioms books are models of expository clarity, yet they are still books on formal mathematics. Hence, they have been reluctantly “starred.”
*Principia Mathematica, volumes I – III, with Bertrand Russell (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1910 – 1913.)
An Introduction to Mathematics (London: Home University Library of Modern Knowledge, 1911. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1958.)
*An Enquiry into the Principles of Natural Knowledge (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1919.)
The Concept of Nature (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1920. Mineola: Dover, May 2004.)
*The Principle of Relativity with Applications to Physical Science (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1922. Mineola: Dover Phoenix Editions, 2004.)
Science and the Modern World (New York: The Macmillan Company, 1925. New York: The Free Press, 1967.)
Religion in the Making (New York: The Macmillan Company, 1926. New York: Fordham University Press, 1996.)
- This later edition is particularly useful because of the detailed glossary of terms at the end of the text.
Symbolism, Its Meaning and Effect (New York: The Macmillan Company, 1927. New York: Fordham University Press, 1985.)
The Aims of Education (New York: The Macmillan Company, 1929. New York: The Free Press, 1967.)
**Process and Reality (New York: The Macmillan Company 1929. New York: The Free Press, 1978.)
- Easily one of the most difficult books in the entire Western philosophical canon, this volume earns two asterisks.
The Function of Reason (Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1929. Boston: Beacon Press, 1962.)
*Adventures of Ideas (New York: The Macmillan Company, 1933. New York: The Free Press, 1985.)
Modes of Thought (New York: The Macmillan Company, 1938. New York: The Free Press, 1968.)
Essays in Science and Philosophy (New York: Philosophical Library Inc., 1948.)

b. Secondary Sources

(Relatively more accessible secondary texts:)

Eastman, Timothy E. and Keeton, Hank (editors): Physics and Whitehead: Quantum, Process, and Experience (Albany: State University of New York Press, January 2004.)
- This is an important recent survey of some of the ways in which Whitehead’s thought is being employed in contemporary physics.
Kraus, Elizabeth M.: The Metaphysics of Experience (New York: Fordham University Press, April 1979.)
- This book is a particularly useful companion to PR because of the care with which Kraus has flow-charted the relational structures of Whitehead’s argument.
Lowe, Victor: Alfred North Whitehead: The Man and his Work, volumes I and II (Baltimore: The Johns Hopkins Press, 1985 & 1990.)
- These volumes are the definitive biography of Whitehead.
Mesle, C. Robert & Cobb, John B.: Process Theology: A Basic Introduction (Atlanta: Chalice Press, September 1994.)
- This is a solid and very readable survey of contemporary process theology.
Schilpp, Paul Arthur, editor: The Philosophy of Alfred North Whitehead, “The Library of Living Philosophers,” (LaSalle: Open Court Publishing Company, 1951.)
- This book is a collection of essays on Whitehead’s work by his contemporaries.

(Relatively more technical secondary texts:)

Casati, Roberto and Varzi, Achille C.: Parts and Places: The Structures of Spatial Representation (Cambridge, MA: The MIT Press, 1999.)
- This text is a college level introduction to mereotopology, and includes an extensive bibliography on the subject and its history.
Ford, Lewis: Emergence of Whitehead’s Metaphysics, 1925-1929 (Albany: SUNY Press, 1985.)
- This book is an examination of the historical development of Whitehead’s metaphysical ideas.
Hall, David L.: The Civilization of Experience, A Whiteheadian Theory of Culture (New York: Fordham University Press, New 1973.)
- Hall’s work attempts, among other things, to derive an ethical theory from Whitehead’s metaphysics.
Jones, Judith A. Intensity: An Essay in Whiteheadian Ontology (Nashville: Vanderbilt University Press, 1998.)
- This work is widely considered to be one of the most important pieces of secondary literature on Whitehead.
Nobo, Jorge Luis.: Whitehead’s Metaphysics of Extension and Solidarity (Albany: SUNY Press, 1986.)
Palter, William: Whitehead’s Philosophy of Science (Chicago: University of Chicago Press, June 1960.)
- This work is widely viewed as the definitive text on Whitehead’s theory of science and nature.

Author Information

Gary L. Herstein
Email: gherstein@netzero.net
Southern Illinois University at Carbondale
U. S. A.

God and Time

Any theistic view of the world includes some notion of how God is related to the structures of the universe, including space and time. The question of God’s relation to time has generated a great amount of theological and philosophical reflection. The traditional view has been that God is timeless in the sense of being outside time altogether; that is, he exists but does not exist at any point in time and he does not experience temporal succession. What may be the dominant view of philosophers today is that he is temporal but everlasting; that is, God never began to exist and he never will go out of existence. He exists at each moment in time.

Deciding how best to think of God’s relation to time will involve bringing to bear one’s views about other aspects of the divine nature. How a philosopher thinks about God’s knowledge and his interaction with his people within the temporal world shapes how that philosopher will think about God’s relation to time and vice versa. In addition, other metaphysical considerations also play important roles in the discussion. For example, the nature of time and the nature of the origin of the universe each have a bearing on whether God is best thought of as timeless or temporal.

This article traces the main contours of the contemporary debate. Several versions of the view that God is timeless are explained and the major arguments for timelessness are developed and criticized. Divine temporality is also explored and arguments in its favor are presented along with criticisms. In addition, some views that attempt to occupy a middle ground will be considered.

God’s Relation to Time — Preliminaries
Methodology
Divine Timelessness
Arguments for Divine Timelessness
Divine Temporality
Arguments for Temporality
1. Divine Action in the World
2. Divine Knowledge of the Present
Some In-between Views
1. Padgett and DeWeese: God as Relatively Timeless
2. Craig: God as Timeless without Creation and Temporal with Creation
Conclusion
References and Further Reading

1. God’s Relation to Time — Preliminaries

Theism is the view that there exists a person who is, in significant ways, unlike every other person. This person, whom we will call “God,” is the creator of the entire universe. Atheism is the view that such a person does not exist. Any theistic world-view includes some notion of how God is related to this universe. There must be some account of how God relates to events, things, and people within the universe and of how God is related to what we could call the structure of the universe. That is, how God is related to space and to time. If God is the creator of the universe, the question arises as to whether God created space and time as well. The answers to these questions turn on whether space and time are parts or aspects of the universe or whether they are more fundamental. Not many theologians or philosophers think that space is more fundamental than the universe. They think that God brought space into being. This view implies that God is in some sense spaceless or “outside” space. God’s relation to time, however, is a topic about which there continues to be deep disagreement. From Augustine through Aquinas, the major thinkers argued that God was not in time at all. They thought of God as eternal, in the sense that he is timeless or atemporal. Now, the dominant view among philosophers is that God is temporal. His eternal nature is thought of as being everlasting rather than timeless. He never came into existence and he will never go out of existence but he exists within time.

Proponents of each of these positions attribute eternality to God. As a result, the term, “eternal” has come to be either ambiguous or a general term that covers various positions. In this article, the term, “eternal” will be used to refer to God’s relation to time, whatever it is. The term “temporal” will refer to God as within time and “timeless” will designate God as being outside time.

a. What it Means to be Temporal: A First Pass

The majority position today, at least among philosophers, is that God is everlasting but temporal. That is, God never began to exist, and he will never go out of existence. God does, however, experience temporal succession. That is, God experiences some events (for example, the first century) before he experiences other events (for example, the twenty-first century.) If God is temporal, his existence and his thoughts and actions have temporal location. He exists at the present moment (and he has existed at each past moment and he will exist at each future moment.) In August, he was thinking about the heat wave in the mid-west. In the thirteenth century, he listened to and answered Aquinas’ prayers for understanding. His dealings, like those of the rest of us, occur at particular times.

b. What it Means to be Timeless: A First Pass

The claim that God is timeless is a denial of the claim that God is temporal. First, God exists, but does not exist at any temporal location. Rather than holding that God is everlastingly eternal, and, therefore, he exists at each time, this position is that God exists but he does not exist at any time at all. God is beyond time altogether. It could be said that although God does not exist at any time God exists at eternity. That is, eternity can be seen as a non-temporal location as any point within time is a temporal location. Second, it is thought that God does not experience temporal succession. God’s relation to each event in a temporal sequence is the same as his relation to any other event. God does not experience the first century before he experiences the twenty-first. Both of these centuries are experienced by God in one “timeless now.” So, while it is true that in the thirteenth century Aquinas prayed for understanding and received it, God’s response to his prayers is not something that also occurred in that century. God, in his timeless state of being, heard Aquinas’ prayers and answered them. He did not first hear them and then answer them. He heard and answered in one timeless moment — in fact, he did so in the same timeless moment that he hears and answers prayers offered in the twenty-first century.

c. Some In-between Views

Some philosophers think that God’s relation to time cannot be captured by either of the categories of temporality or timelessness. Rather, God is in some third kind of relation to time. One in-between position is that God is not within our time, but he is within his own time. In this view, God’s inner life is sequential and, therefore, temporal, but his relation to our temporal sequence is “all at once.” In a sense, God has his own time line. He is not located at any point in our time line. On this view, God’s time does not map onto our time at all. His time is completely distinct from ours.

Another view is that God is “omnitemporal.” It is true on this view as well that God is not in our time, but he experiences temporal succession in his being. Our time is constituted by physical time. God’s time (metaphysical time) has no intrinsic metric and is constituted purely by the divine life itself (Padgett 1992, 2001; DeWeese 2002, 2004). If God is omnitemporal, his metaphysical time does map in some way onto our physical time. So there is a literal sense in which God knows now that I am typing this sentence now.

Another view (Craig, 2001a, 2001b) is that God became temporal when time was created. God’s existence without creation is a timeless existence but once temporal reality comes into existence, God himself must change. If he changes, then he is, at least in some sense, temporal. Just as it is not quite accurate to talk about what happens before time comes into existence, we should not describe this view as one in which God used to be timeless, but he became temporal. This language would imply that there was a time when God was timeless and then, later, there is another time when he is temporal. On this view, there was not a time when he was timeless. God’s timelessness without creation is precisely due to the fact that time came into existence with creation.

2. Methodology

Many philosophers of religion think that the Scriptures do not teach definitively any one view concerning God and time (Craig 2001a, 2001b; for a differing view, see Padgett, 1992). The Scriptures do provide some parameters for acceptable theories of God’s relation to time, however. For example, they teach that God never began to exist and he will never go out of existence. They also teach that God interacts with the world. He knows what is going on, he reveals himself to people, he acts in such a way that things happen in time. They also teach that God is the Lord of all creation. Everything is subject to him. Philosophers generally take claims such as these as parameters for their thinking because of their concern either to remain within historical, biblical orthodoxy themselves or, at least, to articulate a position about God and time that is consistent with orthodoxy. Any departure from the broad outlines of orthodoxy, at least for many Christian philosophers of religion, is made as a last resort.

These parameters, as has been noted, allow for a plurality of positions about how God is related to time. Determining which position is most adequate involves trying to fit what we think about other aspects of God’s nature together with our thinking about God’s relation to time. What we want to say about God’s power or knowledge or omnipresence will have some bearing on our understanding of how it is that God is eternal. In addition, we will try to fit our theories together with other issues besides what God himself is like. Some of the most obvious issues include the nature of time, the nature of change and the creation of the universe.

3. Divine Timelessness

a. Stump and Kretzmann: Timelessness as Duration

Much of the contemporary discussion of timelessness begins with the article “Eternity” by Eleonore Stump and Norman Kretzmann (Stump and Kretzmann, 1981). Stump and Kretzmann take their cue from Boethius who articulated what became a standard understanding of divine timelessness: “Eternity, then, is the whole, simultaneous and perfect possession of boundless life” (Boethius, 1973). Stump and Kretzmann identify four ingredients that they claim are essential to an eternal (timeless) being. (Although they cast their discussion in terms of an “eternal being,” this article will continue to use the term “timeless”.) First, any being that is timeless has life. Second, the life of a timeless thing is not able to be limited. Third, this life involves a special sort of duration. Anything that has life must have duration but the duration of a timeless being is not a temporal duration. Last, a timeless being possesses its entire life all at once. It is this last element that implies that the timeless being is outside time because a temporal living thing only possesses one moment of its life at a time.

The two aspects of divine timelessness that Stump and Kretzmann emphasize are that a timeless being has life and that this life has a duration, though not a temporal duration. The duration of the life of a timeless being puts the nature of such a being in stark contrast with the nature of abstract objects such as numbers or properties. The picture of God that this view leaves us with is of a being whose life is too full to exist only at one moment at a time.

The challenge for a defender of a timeless conception of God is to explain how such a God is related to temporal events. For example, God is directly conscious of each moment of time. The relation of his timeless cognition and the temporal objects of his cognition cannot be captured by using strictly temporal relations such as simultaneity because temporal simultaneity is a transitive relation. God is timelessly aware of the fall of Rome and, in the same timeless now, he is aware of my spilling my coffee. The fall of Rome is not, however, occurring at the same time that my coffee spills. What is needed is some non-transitive notion of God’s relation to the temporal world. To this end, Stump and Kretzmann introduce the notion of “ET (eternal-temporal)-simultaneity:”

(ET) for every x and every y, x and y are ET-simultaneous if and only if:

either x is eternal and y is temporal, or vice versa; and
for some observer, A, in the unique eternal reference frame, x and y are both present — that is, either x is eternally present and y is observed as temporally present, or vice versa; and
for some observer, B, in one of the infinitely many temporal reference frames, x and y are both present — that is, either x is observed as eternally present and y is temporally present, or vice versa. (Stump and Kretzmann, 1981: pp 230-231.)

If x and y are ET-simultaneous, one is timeless and the other temporal. This fact preserves the non-symmetrical and non-transitive nature of the relation. If ET-simultaneity captures the truth about God’s relation to a temporal world, then we do not have to worry about the fall of Rome occurring at the same time that I spill my coffee.

Unfortunately, there are numerous difficulties with ET-simultaneity. Philosophers have complained about obscurity of the use of “reference frame” terminology (for example, Padgett 1992). There is clearly an analogy with relativity theory at work here. To put an analogy at the core of a technical definition is pedagogically suspect, at the least. It may be that it masks a deeper philosophical problem. Furthermore, Delmas Lewis (1984) has argued that a temporal being can observe something only if that thing is itself temporal and a timeless being can observe only what is timeless. Observation cannot cross the temporal/timeless divide. Therefore, the observation talk, as well as the reference frame talk, must be only analogous or metaphorical.

It has also been argued that the notion of atemporal duration, that Stump and Kretzmann hold to be required by the timeless view, is at bottom incoherent. Paul Fitzgerald (1985) has argued that for there to be duration in the life of God, it must be the case that two or more of God’s thoughts, for example, will have either the same or different amounts of duration. Different thoughts in God’s mind can be individuated by their respective lengths of duration or at least by their locations within the duration. Fitzgerald argues that if a timeless duration does not have these analogues with temporal or spatial duration, it is hard to think of it as a case of bona fide duration. On the other hand, if the duration in God’s life has this sort of duration, it is difficult to see that it is not simply one more case of temporal duration.

Stump and Kretzmann attempt to respond to such objections and have revised their analysis of ET-simultaneity accordingly. In their first response to Fitzgerald (Stump and Kretzmann, 1987), they make much of his analyzing timeless duration in a way that makes it incompatible with the traditional doctrine of divine simplicity. They will not accept any notion of God’s life that requires them to give up on the simplicity of the divine nature. For example, there cannot be any sort of sequence among distinct events or “moments” within the duration of God’s life. There are no distinct events or moments at all within the life of a God who is metaphysically simple. Although the two positions are linked throughout medieval thought, there is a cost to holding that a timeless God must be metaphysically simple as well. Any independent argument against divine simplicity (such as in Wolterstorff, 1991) will count against such a view of timelessness.

In a later response, Stump and Kretzmann put forward a new version of ET-simultaneity (called ET’):

(ET’): For every x and every y, x and y are ET-simultaneous if and only if:

either x is eternal and y is temporal or vice versa (assume x is eternal and y temporal);
with respect to some A in the unique eternal reference frame, x and y are both present — that is: (a) x is in the eternal present with respect to A, (b) y is in the temporal present, and (c) both x and y are situated with respect to A in such a way that A can enter into direct and immediate causal relations with each of them and (if capable of awareness) can be directly aware of each of them; and
with respect to some B in one of the infinitely many temporal reference frames, x and y are both present — that is: (a) x is in the eternal present, (b) y is at the same time as B, and (c) both x and y are situated with respect to B in such a way that B can enter into direct and immediate causal relations with each of them and (if capable of awareness) can be directly aware of each of them. (Stump and Kretzmann, 1992)

This version of the principle eliminates the observation difficulties but continues to use the notion of reference frames to describe the timeless and the temporal states. Alan Padgett (1992) has argued that Stump and Kretzmann cannot be defending anything more than a loose analogy with relativity theory here. He points out that they admit that the use of relativity theory is a heuristic device and nothing more. Yet their analysis of the relation between a timeless being and events in time requires more than a loose analogy. As far as the Special Theory of Relativity is concerned, there is an absolute temporal simultaneity or an absolute temporal ordering between any two events within each other’s light cones. The problems with holding that simultaneity is absolute only arise when two events each of which is outside the other’s light cone are considered. If two events are outside each other’s light cones in this way, they cannot causally interact. This feature of Special Relativity makes the analogy of the relations between a timeless being and a temporal event on the one hand and the relations between events in different reference frames quite weak.

b. Leftow: Timelessness as Quasi-Temporal Eternity

Brian Leftow has defended timeless duration in the life of God in another way. He holds that there are distinct moments within God’s life. These moments stand in the successive relations of earlier and later to one another, although they are not temporally earlier or later than one another. Leftow calls this view Quasi-Temporal Eternality (QTE) (Leftow 1991). A QTE being is timeless in that it lives all of its life at once. No moment of its life passes away and there is no moment at which some other moment has not yet been lived. Because the life of a QTE being has sequential moments, its duration is significantly like the duration or extension of the life of a temporal being. Because it experiences all of these moments “at once,” or in the same timeless now, it is a timeless being.

One advantage Leftow thinks his view affords is that it can meet Fitzgerald’s challenges while holding to the doctrine of divine simplicity. There can be the sort of duration that allows discrete moments to be individuated by location in the life of a metaphysically simple, timeless God. Leftow argues that there is a significant difference between a being that has spatial or material parts and a being that has a duration consisting of different moments or positions or points. If the duration of God’s life was made up of discrete parts, God could not be a metaphysically simple being. Points are not parts, however. A finite line segment is not made up of some finite number of points such that the addition or subtraction of a (finite) number of points will change its length. If the points or moments or positions in the duration of the life of God are not to count as parts of that life, they must be of zero finite length.

Fitzgerald had criticized Stump and Kretzmann’s notion of timeless duration by insisting that any duration must be made up of distinct positions. This charge will not affect Leftow’s position. Leftow allows that in the life of a timeless God (and a metaphysically simple God) there are distinct points. He insists that these points are not parts in the life of God. Therefore God is not a being whose life contains distinct parts. He is metaphysically simple. His life does contain points that are ordered sequentially, however. So the QTE God with its sequential points allows God to have the sort of duration that Fitzgerald wanted, yet be timeless. In this way, the QTE concept of timeless duration is more satisfactory than the one put forward by Stump and Kretzmann.

Timeless duration, in Leftow’s understanding, shares features with temporal duration. In a recent essay, he defends the idea that such features can be shared without rendering God temporal (Leftow 2002). He distinguishes between those properties that make something temporal and those that are typically temporal. A typically temporal property (TTP) is a property that is typical of temporal events and which helps make them temporal. Having some TTP is not sufficient to make an event a temporal event, however. What will make an event temporal is having the right TTPs. Leftow notes that nearly everyone who argues that God is timeless also holds that God’s life has at least some TTPs. Similarly, no one who holds that God is temporal thinks that God has every TTP. For example, being wholly future relative to some temporal event is a TTP; but God, even if he is temporal, does not have that property. God has no beginning. As a result his life is not wholly future to any temporal event.

God’s life, like any life, is an event, but it is one in which time does not pass and in which no change takes place. This description captures what is meant by a timeless duration. While having a duration and being an event are each cases of TTPs, Leftow has well-argued that they are not the sort of TTP that only temporal beings can have. God’s life, then, can be a timeless duration.

Which other TTPs does God have if he is timeless? God’s life also has a present, Leftow argues. Having a present is a TTP, but God’s present is a non-temporal present. God’s “now” is not a temporal now. “Now” is the answer to the question asked of some event, “When does it occur?” The term, “now,” according to Leftow, picks out when the speaker tokens it. Not all whens are times, however. Eternity, in the sense of being a timeless location, can also be a when (see also Leftow 1991). “At eternity” can be the answer to the question, “When does God act?”

Leftow’s analysis of these typically temporal properties shows that some of the objections to timeless duration and a timeless God’s relation to a temporal world are not decisive. A timeless God can be present, though not temporally present, to the world. He can have a life which is an event having duration, though not temporal duration. So the critics of Stump and Kretzmann are correct in so far as they argue that these properties are the sort of things that make their bearers temporal. It may be that though things that have these properties are typically temporal, they are not necessarily so.

c. Rogers: Timelessness with No Duration

Katherin Rogers (1994, 2000) has argued that both Leftow and Stump and Kretzmann have not succeeded in articulating a compelling, or even coherent, notion of divine timeless duration. She challenges their claims that the views of timelessness found in Boethius and other medieval thinkers include duration. These texts, she argues, are at best ambiguous. Given their background in Plotinus and Augustine, Rogers argues that it is better not to read these philosophers as attributing duration to the life of God. Augustine and Anselm especially express the notion of timelessness by the use of the notion of the present.

Even if the medieval thinkers did think of timelessness as involving duration, the more difficult question is whether we ought to think about it in this way. Rogers points out that both Stump and Kretzmann and Leftow, in defending the notion of divine timelessness against common objections do not make use of their distinctive notions of timeless duration at all. Furthermore, the explanations given of the coherence of timeless duration are not compelling.

Stump and Kretzmann use the analogy of two parallel lines (Stump and Kretzmann 1987: 219). The higher one is completely illuminated (all at once) while the lower has illuminated a point at a time moving with uniform speed. The light on each line represents the indivisible present. The entirety of the timeless line is one indivisible present while each point on the temporal line is a present (one at a time). In this way the life of God is stretched out, so to speak, alongside temporal reality.

This analogy breaks down at crucial points. Rogers argues that the line representing timelessness (call this line, “E”) either is made of distinct points or it is not. It if is not, then timelessness has no duration. If it is, then these points must correspond in some way to the points on the temporal line (called “T”). The geometric aspect of the analogy is strained considerably when it is seen that some point on T (call it T1) is going to be much closer to a point on E (E1) then the point T235 will be. Yet all of God’s life must stand in the same relation to each point in time, if God is to be truly timeless. Rogers points out that such an analogy is never found in the medieval writers. Their favorite geometric analogy is the circle and the point at the center. The circle represents all of time and the dot, timelessness. Timelessness stands in the same relation to each point along the temporal array. The point itself has no extension or parts.

If God is a QTE being, then his timeless life does have earlier and later points. These are not experienced by God sequentially, however. They are experienced all at once in the one timeless now. Rogers argues that Leftow has two options. Either he must argue for a principled distinction between there being moments in God’s life and his experiencing these moments (such that the moments can exist sequentially but be experienced all at once) or he must grant that earlier and later moments of God’s life can also be simultaneous. Neither alternative increases the plausibility or the clarity of the claim that God’s life has timeless duration.

Rogers offers a non-geometric analogy, found in Augustine (1993), that captures the relation between a timeless God and temporal reality. God’s relation to the world is similar to human memory of the past. Just as in one present mental exercise, a human being can call to mind a whole series of events that are themselves sequential, God in his timeless state can know the whole sequence of temporal events non-sequentially.

Rogers’s position, then, is that God’s timeless life does not involve duration. She does not think that denying duration to God’s life reduces it to some kind of frozen or static existence. These terms are temporal in nature. They each imply a motionless state through a period of time. She writes, “With the exception of lacking extension, God is nothing like a geometric point” (Rogers, 1994, p 14). His life does, however, lack extension.

4. Arguments for Divine Timelessness

Although there are many arguments for the claim that God is timeless, this essay will look at three of the most important. These are arguments concerning God’s knowledge of future free actions, the fullness of God’s life, and God’s creation of the universe. In addition, we will look at some responses to these arguments.

a. God’s Knowledge of the Future

The most prominent argument for divine timelessness is that this position offers a solution to the problem of God’s foreknowledge of free actions. The challenge of reconciling human freedom and divine omniscience is best seen if we presume that God is temporal. If God is omniscient and infallible, he knows every truth, and he is never mistaken. If human beings are free in a libertarian sense, then some actions a person performs are up to her in the sense that she can initiate or refrain from initiating the action. The problem arises if it is supposed that someone will (in the future) choose freely some particular action. Suppose Jeanie will decide tomorrow to make a cup of tea at 4:00 pm. If this is a free act on her part, it must be within her power to make the cup of tea or to refrain from making it. If God is in time and knows everything, then hundreds of years ago, he already knew that Jeanie would make the cup of tea. When tomorrow comes, can Jeanie refrain from making the cup of tea? As Nelson Pike has argued, (Pike 1965) she can do so only if it is within her power to change what it was that God believed from the beginning of time. So, although God has always believed that she would make the tea, she must have the power to change what it was that God believed. She has to be able to make it the case that God always believed that she would not make the cup of tea. Many philosophers have argued that no one has this kind of power over the past, so human freedom is not compatible with divine foreknowledge.

If God is timeless, however, it seems that this problem does not arise. God does not believe things at points in time and Jeanie does not, therefore, have to have power over God’s past beliefs. She does need power over his timeless beliefs. This power is not seen to be problematic because God’s timeless knowledge of an event is thought to be strongly analogous to our present knowledge of an event. It is the occurring of the event that determines the content of our knowledge of the event. So too, it is the occurring of the event that determines the content of God’s knowledge. If Jeanie makes a cup of tea, God knows it timelessly. If she refrains, he knows that she refrains. God’s knowledge is not past but it is timeless.

One might argue that even if God is temporal, the content of his foreknowledge is determined by the occurring of the event in the same way. This claim, of course, is true. There are two items which allow for difficulty here. First, it is only in the case of a temporal God foreknowing Jeanie’s making tea that she needs to have counterfactual power over the past, Second, if God knew a hundred years ago that she was going to make tea, there is a sense in which she can “get in between” God’s knowledge and the event. In other words, the fact that God knows what he knows is fixed before she initiated the event. If it is a free choice on her part, she can still refrain from making the tea. Her decision to make tea or not stands temporally between the content of God’s beliefs and the occurring of the event.

The position that God is timeless is often cited as the best solution to the problem of reconciling God’s knowledge of the future and human freedom. If God is timeless, after all, he does not foreknow anything. Boethius, Anselm, Aquinas and many others have appealed to God’s atemporality to solve this problem.

While the proposal that God is timeless seems to offer a good strategy, at least one significant problem remains. This problem is that of prophecy. Suppose God tells Moses, among other things, that Jeanie will make a cup of tea tomorrow. Now we have a different situation entirely. While God’s knowledge that Jeanie will make a cup of tea is not temporally located, Moses’ knowledge that Jeanie will make tea is temporally located. Furthermore, since the information came from God, Moses cannot be mistaken about the future event (Widerker 1991, Wierenga, 1991).

The prophet problem is a problem, some will argue, only if God actually tells Moses what Jeanie will do. God, it seems, does not tell much to Moses or any other prophet. After all, why should God tell Moses? Moses certainly does not care about Jeanie’s cup of tea. Since prophecy of this sort is pretty rare, we can be confident that God’s knowledge does not rule out our freedom. Some have argued, however, that if it is even possible for God to tell Moses (or anyone else for that matter) what Jeanie will do, then we have a version of the same compatibility problem we would have if we held that God is in time and foreknows her tea making. We could call this version, the “possible prophet” problem. If the possible prophet problem is serious enough to show that God’s timeless knowledge of future acts (future, that is, from our present vantage point) is incompatible with those acts being free, then holding God to be timeless does not solve the problem of foreknowledge.

b. The Fullness of God’s Being

In thinking about God’s nature, we notice that whatever God is, he is to the greatest degree possible. He knows everything that it is possible to know. He can do anything that it is possible to do. He is maximally merciful. This “maximal property idea” can be applied as well to the nature of God’s life. God is a living being. He is not an abstract object like a number. He is not inanimate like a magnetic force. He is alive. If whatever is true of him is true of him to the greatest degree possible, then his life is the fullest life possible. Whatever God’s life is like, he surely has it to the fullest degree.

Some philosophers have argued that this fact about God’s life requires that he be timeless. No being that experiences its life sequentially can have the fullest life possible. Temporal beings experience their lives one moment at a time. The past is gone and the future is not yet. The past part of a person’s life is gone forever. He can remember it, but he cannot experience it directly. The future part of his life is not yet here. He can anticipate it and worry about it, but he cannot yet experience it. He only experiences a brief slice of his life at any one time. The life of a temporal thing, then, is spread out and diffuse.

It is the transient nature of our experience that gives rise to much of the wistfulness and regret we may feel about our lives. This feeling of regret lends credibility to the idea that a sequential life is a life that is less than maximally full. Older people sometimes wish for earlier days, while younger people long to mature. We grieve for the people we love who are now gone. We grieve also for the events and times that no longer persist.

When we think about the life of God, it is strange to think of God longing for the past or for the future. The idea that God might long for some earlier time or regret the passing of some age seems like an attribution of weakness or inadequacy to God. God in his self-sufficiency cannot in any way be inadequate. If it is the experience of the passage of time that grounds these longings, there is good reason not to attribute any experience of time to God. Therefore, it is better to think of God as timeless. He experiences all of his life at once in the timeless present. Nothing of his life is past and nothing of it is future. Boethius’ famous definition of eternity captures this idea: “Eternity, then, is the whole, simultaneous and perfect possession of boundless life” (Boethius, 1973). Boethius contrasts this timeless mode of being with a temporal mode: “Whatever lives in time proceeds in the present and from the past into the future, and there is nothing established in time which can embrace the whole space of its life equally, but tomorrow surely it does not yet grasp, while yesterday it has already lost” (Boethius, 1973).

However, those who think that God is in some way temporal do not want to attribute weakness or inadequacy to God. Nor do they hold that God’s life is less than maximally full. They will deny, rather, that God cannot experience a maximally full life if he is temporal. These philosophers will point out that many of our regrets about the passage of time are closely tied to our finitude. It is our finitude that grounds our own inadequacy, not our temporality. We regret the loss of the past both because our lives are short and because our memories are dim and inaccurate. God’s life, temporal though it may be, is not finite and his memory is perfectly vivid. He does not lose anything with the passage of time. Nor does his life draw closer to its end. If our regrets about the passage of time are more a function of our finitude than of our temporality, much of the force of these considerations is removed.

One important issue that this argument concerning the fullness of God’s life ought to put to rest is the idea that those who hold God to be timeless hold that God is something inert like a number or a property. Whether or not they are correct, the proponent of timelessness holds that it is the fullness of God’s life (rather than its impoverishment) that determines his relation to time.

c. God and the Creation of the Universe

Another argument for God’s timelessness begins with the idea that time itself is contingent. If time is contingent and God is not, then it is at least possible that God exist without time. This conclusion is still far from the claim that God is, in fact, timeless but perhaps we can say more. If time is contingent, then it depends upon God for its existence. Either God brought time into existence or he holds it in existence everlastingly. (The claim that time is contingent, though, is not uncontroversial. Arguments for the necessity of time will be considered below.)

If God created time as part of his creation of the universe, then it is important whether or not the universe had a beginning at all. Although it might seem strange to think that God could create the universe even if the universe had no beginning, it would not be strange to philosophers such as Thomas Aquinas. Working within the Aristotelean framework, he considered an everlasting universe to be a very real possibility. He argued (in his third way) that even a universe with an infinite past would need to depend upon God for its existence. In his view, even if time had no beginning, it was contingent. God sustains the universe, and time itself, in existence at each moment that it exists.

The majority position today is that the universe did have a beginning. What most people mean by this claim is that the physical universe began. It is an open question for many whether time had a beginning or whether the past is infinite. If the past is infinite, then it is metaphysical time and not physical time that is everlasting. Arguments such as the Kalam Cosmological Argument aim to show that it is not possible that the past is infinite (Craig and Smith, 1993; Craig 2001b). Suppose time came into existence with the universe so that the universe has only a finite past. This means that physical time was created by God. It may be the case that metaphysical time is infinite or that God created “pure duration” (metaphysical time) also. In the latter case, God had to be timeless. God created both physical and metaphysical time and God existed entirely without time. God, then, had to be timeless. Unless God became temporal at some point, God remains timeless.

5. Divine Temporality

The position that God is temporal sometimes strikes the general reader as a position that limits the nature of God. Philosophers who defend divine temporality are committed to a similar methodology to that held by those who are defenders of timelessness. They aim to work within the parameters of historical, biblical orthodoxy and to hold to the maximal property idea that whatever God is, he is to the greatest possible degree. Thus, proponents of divine temporality will hold that God is omniscient and omnipotent. God’s temporality is not seen as a limit to his power or his knowledge or his being. Those who hold to a temporal God often work on generating solutions to the challenge of divine foreknowledge and human freedom. They work within the notion that God knows whatever can be known and is thus omniscient. Even those philosophers who argue that God cannot know future free actions defend divine omniscience. They either think that there are no truths about future free actions or that none of those truths can be known, even by God (Hasker, 1989 and Pinnock et al., 1994). God is omniscient because he knows everything that can be known. Divine temporality is not a departure from orthodox concepts of God.

In fact, it is often the commitment to biblical orthodoxy itself that generates the arguments that God is best thought of as temporal. After all, the Pslamist affirms that God is ‘from everlasting to everlasting.’ (Psalm 90:2) It looks like what is affirmed is God’s everlasting temporality. Two of these arguments will be discussed: the argument that divine action in the world requires temporality and the argument that God’s knowledge of tensed facts requires that he be temporal.

6. Arguments for Temporality

a. Divine Action in the World

God acts in the world. He created the universe and he sustains it in existence. God’s sustaining the universe in its existence at each moment is what keeps the universe existing from moment to moment. If, at any instant, it were not sustained, it would cease to exist. If God sustains the universe by performing different actions at different moments of time, then he changes from moment to moment. If God changes, then he is temporal.

God’s interventions in the world are often interactions with human beings. He redeems his people, answers their prayer, and forgives their sin. He also comes to their aid and comforts and strengthens them. Can a proponent of divine timelessness make sense of God interacting in these ways? It all depends, of course, on what the necessary conditions for interaction turn out to be. If it is not possible to answer a request (a prayer) unless the action is performed after the request, then the fact that God answers prayer will guarantee that he is temporal. Some thinkers have thought that an answer can be initiated only after a request. Others have argued that, although answers to requests normally come after the request, it is not necessary that they do so. In order to count as an answer, the action must occur because of the request. Not any because of relation will do, however. An answer is not normally thought of as being caused by the request, yet a cause-effect relation is a kind of because of relation. Answers are contingent whereas effects of causes are in some sense necessary. The because of relation that is relevant to answering a request has to do with intention or purpose.

In some cases, it seems that it is not necessary for the request to come before the answer. If a father knows that his daughter will come home and ask for a peanut butter sandwich, he can make the sandwich ahead of time. There is some sense in which he is responding to her request, even if he has not yet been asked. If the relation between a request and an answer is not necessarily a temporal one, then a timeless God can answer prayer. He hears all our prayers in his one timeless conscious act and in that same conscious act, he wills the answers to our various requests.

Perhaps the effects of God’s actions are located successively in time but his acting is not. In one eternal act he wills the speaking to Moses at one time and the parting of the sea at another. So Moses hears God speaking from the bush at one time and much later Moses sees God part the sea. But in God’s life and consciousness, these actions are not sequential. He wills timelessly both the speaking and the parting. The sequence of the effects of God’s timeless will does not imply that God’s acts themselves are temporal.

b. Divine Knowledge of the Present

Although God’s knowledge of the future is thought by many to be a strong support for divine timelessness, many philosophers think that God’s knowledge of the present strongly supports his temporality. If God knows everything, he must know what day it is today. If God is timeless, so the argument goes, he cannot know what day it is today. Therefore, he must be temporal. (This argument is put forward in various ways by Craig, 2001a, 2001b; DeWeese, 2004; Hasker, 2002; Kretzmann, 1966; Padgett, 1992, 2001 and Wolterstorff, 1975.)

To get at the claim that a timeless God cannot know what day it is, we can start with the facts that a timeless God cannot change and that God knows everything it is possible to know. But if God knows that today is December 13, 2006, tomorrow he will know something else. He will know that yesterday it was December 13, 2006 and that today is December 14, 2006. So God must know different things at different times. If the contents of God’s knowledge changes, he changes. If he changes, he is temporal and not timeless.

The quick answer to this concern is to deny that God knows something different at different times. First, it is obvious that someone who holds that God is timeless does not think that God knows things at times at all. God’s knowings are not temporally located even if what he knows is temporally located. It is not true, it will be insisted, that God knows something today. He knows things about today but he knows these things timelessly.

God knows that today is December 13 in that he knows that the day I refer to when I use the word “today” in writing this introduction is December 13. When we raise the question again tomorrow (“Can a timeless God know what day it is today?”), God knows that this second use of “today” refers to December 14. Temporal indexical terms such as “today,” “tomorrow,” and “now” refer to different temporal locations with different uses. In this way they are similar to terms such as “here,” “you,” and “me.” The point is that the meaning of any sentence involving an indexical term depends upon the context of its use. Since indexical terms may refer to different items with different uses, we can make such sentences more clear by replacing the indexical term with a term whose reference is fixed.

The sentence, “I am now typing this sentence” can be clarified by replacing the indexical terms with other terms that make the indexicals explicit. For example, “I type this sentence at 11:58 AM (EST) on December 13, 2006.” Even better is “Ganssle types this sentence at 11:58 AM (EST) on December 13, 2006.” These sentences, it can be claimed, express the same proposition. In the same way, “I am now writing here” can be clarified as “Ganssle writes on December 13, 2006 at11:58 AM (EST) in Panera Bread in Hamden, CT.” God, of course, knows all of the propositions expressed by these non-indexical sentences. Furthermore, the content of his knowledge does not need to change day to day. The proposition expressed by a non-indexical sentence is true timelessly (or everlastingly) if it is true at all. The proposition expressed by the sentence, “Ganssle types this sentence at 11:58 AM (EST) on December 13, 2006” will be true tomorrow and the next day and so on. God can know these things and be changeless. He can, therefore, be timeless.

There are many philosophers who reject this quick answer on the grounds that God can know all of the non-indexical propositions and still not know what is happening now. This kind of objection raises the second approach to the question of a timeless God’s knowledge of the present. This approach is not through change but through omniscience. I can know that you type a sentence at some date (call the date, t₁) without knowing whether or not you are typing the sentence now. I might fail to know that t₁ is now. A timeless God can know all propositions expressed by sentences of the form “event e occurs at t_n.” Sentences of the form, “event e occurs now,” so the objection goes, express different propositions. In order for God to be omniscient, he must know all propositions. If some sentences are essentially indexical (if they do not express the same propositions as sentences of the form “event e occurs at t_n“), he cannot know them. If a timeless God cannot know this kind of proposition, he is not omniscient.

There have been two basic kinds of responses to this line of argument. The first is to deny that there are propositions that are irreducibly indexical in this way. In knowing every proposition of the form “event e occurs at t_n,” God knows every proposition about events. This response is, in effect, a defense of the quick answer given above. While this position has its adherents, it involves a commitment to the B-theory of time. The B-theory of time (also known as the tenseless theory or the stasis theory) entails the claim that the most fundamental features of time are the relations of “before,” “after,” and “simultaneous with.” Talk of tenses (past, present and future) can be reduced to talk about these relations. The temporal now is not an objective feature of reality but is a feature of our experience of reality. If the B-theory of time is true, this objection to divine timelessness is undermined.

Those who think that there are propositions about events that cannot be reduced to propositions of the form “event e occurs at t_n,” hold the A-theory of time (or tensed or process theory.) The A-theory claims that there is an objective temporal now. This now is not a feature only of our subjective experience of reality but it is a piece of the furniture of the universe. Another way to explain this is that even if there were no temporal minds, the property of occurring now would be exemplified by some events and not others. There would be facts about what is happening now. The fundamental temporal properties are the tensed properties. So events objectively are past, present or future. They are not past, present or future only in virtue of their relation to other events. (The distinction between the A-theory and the B-theory of time was first articulated by J. M. E. McTaggart; see McTaggart, 1993.)

There are different versions of the A-theory and different versions of the B-theory. It is not for this essay to canvass all of these versions or to weigh the evidence for or against any of them. (For more information, see Le Poidevin and MacBeath, 1993; Oaklander and Smith, 1994; and the section “Are there Essentially Tensed Facts?” of the article on Time in this encyclopedia.) Suffice it to say that the A-theory is held more commonly than the B-theory. If the claim that all propositions about events can be reduced to propositions of the form “event e occurs at tn” entails a controversial theory of time, it will not be as successful a defense as many would like. This consideration, to be sure, does not mean that it might not be the correct response, but the burden of defending it is greater accordingly.

Another sort of response to the claim that divine omniscience requires that God is temporal is to embrace the conclusion of the argument and to hold that God is not propositionally omniscient even if he is factually omniscient. In other words, God knows every fact but there are some propositions that can be known only by minds that are located indexically. God is not lacking any fact. His access to each fact, though, is not indexical (Wierenga, 1989, 2002). He knows the same fact I know when I think “I am writing here today.” The proposition through which he knows this fact, however, is different than the proposition through which I know it. God knows the fact through the non-indexical proposition “Ganssle writes in Panera on December 13, 2006.” Embracing this solution is not without its costs. First of all we have to adjust how we describe God’s omniscience. We cannot describe it in terms of God’s knowing every proposition. It is not true, on this view, that God knows every proposition. God knows every fact.

One way to object to this view is to deny that propositions expressed by indexical and non- indexical sentences refer to or assert the same fact. To take this road is to hold that some facts are essentially indexical rather than just that some sentences or propositions are. This objection does not seem too plausible because of stories like the following. Suppose you assert to me (truly) “You are in the kitchen,” and I assert to you (also truly), “I am in the kitchen.” These sentences are not identical and, according to the view we are considering, they express different propositions. What makes both of these assertions true is one and the same fact; the fact consisting in a particular person (Ganssle) being in a particular place (the kitchen). My knowledge of this fact is mediated through a proposition that is expressed by sentences using the indexical “I” and your knowledge is mediated through propositions expressed by sentences using “you.” If there is one fact that makes these different indexical sentences true, it seems that there can be one fact that makes the following two indexical sentences true: “Ganssle is now typing” and “Ganssle types on December 13, 2006.” If these sentences are made true by the same fact, God can know all facts even if he does not know some facts in the same we know them. Our knowledge of facts is conditioned by our indexical location. That is, we know them the way we do in virtue of our personal, spatial and temporal coordinates.

A third response is possible. This response can be combined with the second and that is to deny that God’s knowledge is mediated by propositions at all. William Alston has argued that God knows what he knows without having any beliefs. God’s knowledge is constituted instead by direct awareness of the facts involved. This view entails that God’s omniscience is not to be cashed out in terms of propositions. Furthermore, if God’s knowledge of a fact consists in the presence of that fact to God’s consciousness, it may be that this presence does not affect God intrinsically. If this is the case, God can be aware of different facts in their different temporal locations without himself changing. Whether a strategy such as this one will succeed is an open question (Alston 1989; Ganssle 1993, 1995, 2002c).

Many philosophers who argue for divine temporality structure their arguments as follows: If God is timeless, the B-theory of time must be true. But the B-theory of time is false. Therefore, God is not timeless. Philosophers who defend divine timelessness, then, take one of two tacks. Either they embrace the first premise and hold to the B-theory of time (Helm 1988, 2001; Rogers 2000) or they argue against the second premise. God can be timeless even if the A-theory of time is true. In this case, they try to show that a timeless God can know tensed facts without changing himself. Some advocates of timelessness will try to reconcile their view with the A-theory whether or not it is the theory of time they hold. Since the A-theory is the more widely held, showing God’s timelessness to be compatible with it helps strengthen the overall case for timelessness.

7. Some In-between Views

a. Padgett and DeWeese: God as Relatively Timeless

Alan Padgett and Gary DeWeese (Padgett 1992, 2001; DeWeese 2002, 2004) have each argued that God is not in physical time although he is everlastingly temporal. God’s time is metaphysical time. Padgett and DeWeese, as is to be expected, emphasize different things in the details. For example, Padgett allows for the coherence of a timeless God while DeWeese would endorse the view that any timeless entity is causally inert. No person, then, can be timeless. Only abstract objects such as numbers and properties can exist outside time. Nevertheless, their positions are similar enough to treat them together. The claim that God is “relatively timeless” or “omnitemporal” allows its proponents to endorse some of the criticisms of divine timelessness and, at the same time, affirm some of the arguments for timelessness. Each affirms the argument that God can be timeless only if the B-theory of time is true and that the B-theory is false. They also can hold that God’s life cannot be contained in the measured moments of physical time. They each also affirm that God created time (physical time) as he created the physical universe.

It is with these latter claims that they make the distinction between physical and metaphysical time. Physical time is metric time. In other words, it is time that has an intrinsic metric due to regularities in the physical universe. Events such as the earth revolving around the sun are regular enough to mark off units of time. Metaphysical time involves no metric or measured temporal intervals. God, in himself, is immune from temporal measure. These temporal items depend upon the physical measure of time. This measure is a function of the regular processes that follow physical laws. Since God is not subject to the laws of nature, he is not subject to measured time. He does experience a temporal now, somewhat as we do, but his intrinsic experience is not measured by regular, law-like intervals. He experiences temporal succession, but this succession is that of the progression of his own consciousness and actions rather than that of any external constraints. Now that God has created a universe that unfolds according to regular laws, there is a metric within created time. So while God’s now coincides with the now of physical time, the measured intervals do not belong to his divine life.

These positions combine some of the strengths both of the temporalist with strengths of the timelessness position. The challenge might consist in finding a stable middle ground between timelessness and temporality. When metaphysical time is described as being without metric and without law-like intervals, and perhaps even that God does not change before physical time is created, it becomes more difficult to see the difference between this position and timelessness. The main difference is that on this view, God remains temporal and capable of change even when no change happens in the divine life (for example, before creation). On the other hand, when the co-location of God’s experience of his now and the now of physical time is emphasized, the distinction between the two becomes more difficult to see. William Lane Craig, who holds a similar position, identifies God’s time with the absolute time that was posited by Newton (Craig 2001a, 2001b, 2002). With this notion in place, one can see that physical time is that to which the Special Theory of Relativity applies. Craig and others insist that if relativity theory is interpreted along neo-Lorentzian lines rather than along the lines recommended by Einstein, there is room for a privileged reference frame and, therefore, a cosmic time (Craig 2002). But this cosmic or “absolute” time may still apply only to this universe and not to God.

b. Craig: God as Timeless without Creation and Temporal with Creation

William Lane Craig’s own position includes another variation. He holds that God is temporal in that he is within metaphysical time. This feature of God’s life is due to the creation of time. Once God created the universe, he became temporal. Prior to creation, God was timeless. Of course, it is not right to say “prior to creation” in any literal sense. The way Craig describes his view is that God without creation is timeless; God with creation is temporal.

If God has shifted his eternal position in this way, then some of the arguments against timelessness or against temporality will have to be rejected. For example, God in his timeless state is omniscient. He is not lacking any knowledge at all. God must know, in his timeless state, that I am typing now. If God (without creation) can know that I am typing now, then it seems that a timeless God with creation can know that I am typing now. Therefore, God’s timelessness is not incompatible with the A-theory of time (Hasker 2003). Craig’s response is that until the universe is created, there is no time and so all tensed propositions are false. What God, in his timeless state without creation knows is the tenseless proposition “Ganssle types on December 14, 2006.” Once the universe is created, time is real and these tenseless sentences do not capture all the facts there are. In order to be omniscient once time exists, God must also know that I type now.

The challenge with this response is that it appears to endorse some of the strategies to make the B-theory work. Remember the A-theory of time is the view that the most fundamental things about time are the locations of past, present and future. The B-theory holds that the most fundamental aspects of time are the relations before, after, and simultaneous with. On Craig’s view, it is hard to argue that the A-locations are more fundamental than the B-relations when there can be facts of the B-sort that have no A-locations. Without creation, it is a fact that I type this sentence on December 14, 2006. Once time is created, there are further facts such as whether I type it now, or have already done so. The fact that I type it on December 14 seems to be more fundamental than the facts that come into existence when time is created.

Craig’s position raises another interesting question. Is it possible for a timeless being to become temporal or for a temporal being to become timeless? The philosophers whose views have been discussed will disagree about the answer to this question. Stump and Kretzmann, for example, would not think such a change possible. Their view of divine timelessness is deeply connected with divine simplicity which, in turn, is seen to be part of God’s essential nature. DeWeese also would not allow for this sort of change since no timeless being can be a person or stand in any causal relations on his view. Craig thinks that it is possible.

8. Conclusion

Questions about God’s relation to time involve many of the most perplexing topics in metaphysics. These include the nature of the fundamental structures of the universe as well as the nature of God’s own life. It is not surprising that the questions are still open even after over two millennia of careful inquiry. While philosophers often come to conclusions that are reasonably settled in their mind, they are wise to hold such conclusions with an open hand.

9. References and Further Reading

Alston, William P. (1989). “Does God Have Beliefs?” in Divine Nature and Human Language. Ithaca: Cornell University Press: 178-193.
Aquinas. (1945). Introduction to St. Thomas Aquinas. ed., Anton C. Pegis New York: Modern Library.
Augustine. (1960). The Confessions of St. Augustine. trans. John K Ryan. New York: Image Books.
Augustine. (1993). On Free Choice of the Will. trans. Thomas Williams. Indianapolis: Hackett.
Boethius. (1973). Tractates; The Consolation of Philosophy. Translated by H. F. Stewart and E. K. Rand, and S. J. Tester. (Loeb Classical Library) Cambridge: Harvard University Press.
Castaneda, Hector Neri. (1967) “Omniscience and Indexical Reference,” The Journal of Philosophy 64: 203 210.
Craig, William Lane and Quentin Smith. (1993). Theism, Atheism, and Big Bang Cosmology. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Craig, William Lane. (2001a). Time and Eternity: Exploring God’s Relationship to Time. Wheaton, IL: Crossway Books.
Craig, William Lane. (2001b). “Timelessness and Omnitemporality,” in Ganssle (2001a): 129-160.
Craig, William Lane. (2002). “The Elimination of Absolute Time by the Special Theory of Relativity,” in Ganssle and Woodruff (2002): 129-152.
DeWeese, Garrett J. (2002) “Atemporal, Sempiternal or Omnitemporal: God’s Temporal Mode of Being,” in Ganssle and Woodruff (2002a): 49-61.
DeWeese, Garrett J. (2004). God and the Nature of Time. Hampshire UK: Ashgate.
Fitzgerald, Paul. (1985). “Stump and Kretzmann on Time and Eternity,” The Journal of Philosophy 82: 260 269.
Ganssle, Gregory E. (1993). “Atemporality and the Mode of Divine Knowledge,” International Journal for the Philosophy of Religion, 34: 171-180.
Ganssle, Gregory E. (1995). “Leftow on Direct Awareness and Atemporality,” Sophia 34: 30-3.
Ganssle, Gregory E. (2001a) ed., God and Time: Four Views. Downers Grove, IL: Inter Varsity Press.
Ganssle, Gregory E. (2001b). “Introduction: Thinking about God and Time,” in Ganssle (2001a): 9-27.
Ganssle, Gregory E. and David M. Woodruff (2002a) ed., God and Time: Essays on the Divine Nature. New York: Oxford University Press.
Ganssle, Gregory E. (2002b). “Introduction,” in Ganssle and Woodruff (2002a): 3-18.
Ganssle, Gregory E. (2002c). “Direct Awareness and God’s Experience of a Temporal Now,” in Ganssle and Woodruff (2002a): 165-181.
Hasker, William.(1989). God, Time, and Knowledge. Ithaca: Cornell University Press.
Hasker, William. (2002). “The Absence of a Timeless God,” in Ganssle and Woodruff (2002a): 182-206.
Hasker, William. (2003). “Review of God and Time: Four Views ed., Gregory E. Ganssle and God, Time and Eternity by William Lane Craig,” International Journal for the Philosophy of Religion 54: 111-114.
Helm, Paul. (1988). Eternal God: A Study of God without Time. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
Helm, Paul. (2001). “Divine Timeless Eternity,” in Ganssle (2001a): 28-60.
Kretzmann, Norman. (1966). “Omniscience and Immutability,” The Journal of Philosophy 63: 409 421.
Leftow, Brian. (1991). Time and Eternity. Ithaca: Cornell University Press.
Leftow, Brian. (2002). “The Eternal Present,” in Ganssle and Woodruff (2002a): 21-48.
Le Poidevin, Robin and Murray MacBeath (1993) ed., Philosophy of Time. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Lewis, Delmas. (1984). “Eternity Again: A Reply to Stump and Kretzmann,” International Journal for Philosophy of Religion 15: 73-79.
McTaggart, J.M.E. (1993). “The Unreality of Time,” in Le Poidevin, Robin and Murray MacBeath: 23-34.
Oaklander, L. Nathan and Quentin Smith (1994) ed., The New Theory of Time. New Haven: Yale University Press.
Padgett, Alan G. (1992). God, Eternity and the Nature of Time. London: Macmillan. (Reprint, Wipf and Stock, 2000).
Padgett, Alan G. (2001). “Eternity as Relative Timelessness,” in Ganssle (2001a): 92-110.
Pike, Nelson. (1965). “Divine Omniscience and Voluntary Action,” Philosophical Review 74: 27- 46.
Pike, Nelson. (1970). God and Timelessness. New York: Schocken Books.
Pinnock, Clark, Richard Rice, John Sanders, William Hasker, David Basinger. (1994). The Openness of God: A Biblical Challenge to the Traditional Understanding of God. Downers Grove: Inter Varsity Press.
Prior, Arthur N. (1993). “Changes in Events and Changes in Things,” in Le Poidevin, Robin and Murray MacBeath: 35-46.
Rogers, Katherin A. (1994). “Eternity has no Duration.” Religious Studies 30: 1-16.
Rogers, Katherin A. (2000). Perfect Being Theology. Edinburgh: Edinburgh University Press.
Stump, Eleonore and Norman Kretzmann. (1981). “Eternity,” Journal of Philosophy 78: 429-458. Reprinted in The Concept of God, edited by Thomas V. Morris. New York: Oxford University Press, 1987: 219-252.
Stump, Eleonore and Norman Kretzmann. (1987). “Atemporal Duration: A Reply to Fitzgerald,” Journal of Philosophy 84: 214-219.
Stump, Eleonore and Norman Kretzmann. (1991). “Prophecy, Past Truth and Eternity,” Philosophical Perspectives 5 ed., James Tomberlin: 395-424.
Stump, Eleonore and Norman Kretzmann. (1992). “Eternity, Awareness, and Action,” Faith and Philosophy 9: 463-482.
Swinburne, Richard. (1977). The Coherence of Theism. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
Swinburne, Richard. (1993). “God and Time,” in Reasoned Faith edited by Eleonore Stump. Ithaca: Cornell University Press: 204-222.
Swinburne, Richard. (1994). The Christian God. Oxford: Clarendon.
Widerker, David. (1991). “A Problem for the Eternity Solution,” International Journal for the Philosophy of Religion 29: 87-95.
Wierenga, Edward R. (1989). The Nature of God: An Inquiry into Divine Attributes. Ithaca: Cornell University Press.
Wierenga, Edward R. (1991). “Prophecy, Freedom and the Necessity of the Past,” Philosophical Perspectives 5 ed., James Tomberlin: 425-445.
Wierenga, Edward R. (2002). “Timelessness out of Mind,” in Ganssle and Woodruff (2002a): 153-164.
Wolterstorff, Nicholas. (1975). “God Everlasting,” in God and the Good: Essays in Honor of Henry Stob, ed. Clifton Orlebeke and Lewis Smedes. Grand Rapids: Eerdmans. Reprinted in Contemporary Philosophy of Religion, ed. Steven M. Cahn and David Shatz. New York: Oxford University Press, 1982: 77-89.
Wolterstorff, Nicholas. (1991). “Divine Simplicity,” Philosophical Perspectives 5: Philosophy of Religion edited by James Tomberlin: 531-552.
Wolterstorff, Nicholas. (2001). “Unqualified Divine Temporality,” in Ganssle (2001a): 187-213.

Author Information

Gregory E. Ganssle
Email: gregory.ganssle@yale.edu
Yale University
U. S. A.

Environmental Ethics

The field of environmental ethics concerns human beings’ ethical relationship with the natural environment. While numerous philosophers have written on this topic throughout history, environmental ethics only developed into a specific philosophical discipline in the 1970s. This emergence was no doubt due to the increasing awareness in the 1960s of the effects that technology, industry, economic expansion and population growth were having on the environment. The development of such awareness was aided by the publication of two important books at this time. Rachel Carson’s Silent Spring, first published in 1962, alerted readers to how the widespread use of chemical pesticides was posing a serious threat to public health and leading to the destruction of wildlife. Of similar significance was Paul Ehrlich’s 1968 book, The Population Bomb, which warned of the devastating effects the spiraling human population has on the planet’s resources. Of course, pollution and the depletion of natural resources have not been the only environmental concerns since that time: dwindling plant and animal biodiversity, the loss of wilderness, the degradation of ecosystems, and climate change are all part of a raft of “green” issues that have implanted themselves into both public consciousness and public policy over subsequent years. The job of environmental ethics is to outline our moral obligations in the face of such concerns. In a nutshell, the two fundamental questions that environmental ethics must address are: what duties do humans have with respect to the environment, and why? The latter question usually needs to be considered prior to the former. In order to tackle just what our obligations are, it is usually thought necessary to consider first why we have them. For example, do we have environmental obligations for the sake of human beings living in the world today, for humans living in the future, or for the sake of entities within the environment itself, irrespective of any human benefits? Different philosophers have given quite different answers to this fundamental question which, as we shall see, has led to the emergence of quite different environmental ethics.

Extending Moral Standing
Radical Ecology
The Future of Environmental Ethics
References and Further Reading

1. Extending Moral Standing

As noted above, perhaps the most fundamental question that must be asked when regarding a particular environmental ethic is simply, what obligations do we have concerning the natural environment? If the answer is simply that we, as human beings, will perish if we do not constrain our actions towards nature, then that ethic is considered to be “anthropocentric.” Anthropocentrism literally means “human-centeredness,” and in one sense all ethics must be considered anthropocentric. After all, as far as we know, only human beings can reason about and reflect upon ethical matters, thus giving all moral debate a definite “human-centeredness.” However, within environmental ethics anthropocentrism usually means something more than this. It usually refers to an ethical framework that grants “moral standing” solely to human beings. Thus, an anthropocentric ethic claims that only human beings are morally considerable in their own right, meaning that all the direct moral obligations we possess, including those we have with regard to the environment, are owed to our fellow human beings.

While the history of western philosophy is dominated by this kind anthropocentrism, it has come under considerable attack from many environmental ethicists. Such thinkers have claimed that ethics must be extended beyond humanity, and that moral standing should be accorded to the non-human natural world. Some have claimed that this extension should run to sentient animals, others to individual living organisms, and still others to holistic entities such as rivers, species and ecosystems. Under these ethics, we have obligations in respect of the environment because we actually owe things to the creatures or entities within the environment themselves. Determining whether our environmental obligations are founded on anthropocentric or non-anthropocentric reasoning will lead to different accounts of what those obligations are. This section examines the prominent accounts of moral standing within environmental ethics, together with the implications of each.

a. Human Beings

Although many environmental philosophers want to distance themselves from the label of anthropocentrism, it nevertheless remains the case that a number of coherent anthropocentric environmental ethics have been elaborated (Blackstone, 1972; Passmore, 1974; O’Neill, 1997; and Gewirth, 2001). This should be of little surprise, since many of the concerns we have regarding the environment appear to be concerns precisely because of the way they affect human beings. For example, pollution diminishes our health, resource depletion threatens our standards of living, climate change puts our homes at risk, the reduction of biodiversity results in the loss of potential medicines, and the eradication of wilderness means we lose a source of awe and beauty. Quite simply then, an anthropocentric ethic claims that we possess obligations to respect the environment for the sake of human well-being and prosperity.

Despite their human-centeredness, anthropocentric environmental ethics have nevertheless played a part in the extension of moral standing. This extension has not been to the non-human natural world though, but instead to human beings who do not yet exist. The granting of moral standing to future generations has been considered necessary because of the fact that many environmental problems, such as climate change and resource depletion, will affect future humans much more than they affect present ones. Moreover, it is evident that the actions and policies that we as contemporary humans undertake will have a great impact on the well-being of future individuals. In light of these facts, some philosophers have founded their environmental ethics on obligations to these future generations (Gewirth, 2001).

Of course, it is one thing to say that human beings in the future have moral standing, it is quite another to justify the position. Indeed, some philosophers have denied such standing to future people, claiming that they lie outside of our moral community because they cannot act reciprocally (Golding, 1972). So, while we can act so as to benefit them, they can give us nothing in return. This lack of reciprocity, so the argument goes, denies future people moral status. However, other philosophers have pointed to the fact that it is usually considered uncontroversial that we have obligations to the dead, such as executing their wills and so on, even though they cannot reciprocate (Kavka, 1978). While still others have conceded that although any future generation cannot do anything for us, it can nevertheless act for the benefit of its own subsequent generations, thus pointing to the existence of a broader transgenerational reciprocity (Gewirth, 2001).

However, perhaps we do not have obligations to future people because there is no definitive group of individuals to whom such obligations are owed. This argument is not based on the simple fact that future people do not exist yet, but on the fact that we do not know who they will be. Derek Parfit has called this the “non-identity problem” (Parfit, 1984, ch. 16). The heart of this problem lies in the fact that the policies adopted by states directly affect the movement, education, employment and so on of their citizens. Thus, such policies affect who meets whom, and who has children with whom. So, one set of policies will lead to one group of future people, while another set will lead to a different group. Our actions impact who will exist in the future, making our knowledge of who they will be incomprehensible. Since there is no definitive set of future people to receive the benefits or costs of our actions, to whom do we grant moral standing? Secondly, and of particular importance for environmental ethics, how could any future people legitimately complain that they have been wronged by our environmentally destructive policies? For if we had not conducted such policies, they would not even exist.

In response to the non-identity problem, it has been argued that while we do not know exactly who will exist in the future, we do know that some group of people will exist and that they will have interests. In light of this, perhaps our obligations lie with these interests, rather than the future individuals themselves (DesJardins, 2001, p. 74). As for the second aspect of the problem, we might claim that although future generations will benefit from our environmentally destructive policies by their very existence, they will nevertheless have been harmed. After all, cannot one be harmed by a particular action even if one benefits overall? To illustrate this point, James Woodward gives the example of a racist airline refusing to allow a black man on a flight that subsequently crashes (Woodward, 1986). Isn’t this man harmed by the airline, even though he benefits overall?

Even if we do decide to grant moral standing to future human beings, however, that still leaves the problem of deciding just what obligations we have to them. One set of difficulties relates to our ignorance of who they are. For not only do we lack information about the identity of future people, but we have neither knowledge of their conceptions of a good life, nor what technological advances they may have made. For example, why bother preserving rare species of animal or oil reserves if humans in the future receive no satisfaction from the diversity of life and have developed some alternative fuel source? Our ignorance of such matters makes it very difficult to flesh out the content of our obligations.

By way of reply to such problems, some philosophers have argued that while we do not know everything about future people, we can make some reasonable assumptions. For example, Brian Barry has argued that in order to pursue their idea of the good life – whatever that happens to be – future people will have need of some basic resources, such as food, water, minimum health and so on (Barry, 1999). Barry thus argues that our obligations lie with ensuring that we do not prevent future generations from meeting their basic needs. This, in turn, forces us to consider and appropriately revise our levels of pollution, resource depletion, climate change and population growth. While this might seem a rather conservative ethic to some, it is worth pointing out that at no time in humanity’s history have the needs of contemporaries been met, let alone those of future people. This unfortunate fact points to a further problem that all future-oriented anthropocentric environmental ethics must face. Just how are the needs and interests of the current generation to be weighed against the needs and interests of those human beings in the future? Can we justifiably let present people go without for the sake of future humans?

Clearly then, the problems posed by just a minimal extension of moral standing are real and difficult. Despite this, however, most environmental philosophers feel that such anthropocentric ethics do not go far enough, and want to extend moral standing beyond humanity. Only by doing this, such thinkers argue, can we get the beyond narrow and selfish interests of humans, and treat the environment and its inhabitants with the respect they deserve.

b. Animals

If only human beings have moral standing, then it follows that if I come across a bear while out camping and shoot it dead on a whim, I do no wrong to that bear. Of course, an anthropocentric ethic might claim that I do some wrong by shooting the bear dead – perhaps shooting bears is not the action of a virtuous individual, or perhaps I am depleting a source of beauty for most other humans – but because anthropocentrism states that only humans have moral standing, then I can do no wrong to the bear itself. However, many of us have the intuition that this claim is wrong. Many of us feel that it is possible to do wrong to animals, whether that be by shooting innocent bears or by torturing cats. Of course, a feeling or intuition does not get us very far in proving that animals have moral standing. For one thing, some people (hunters and cat-torturers, for example) no doubt have quite different intuitions, leading to quite different conclusions. However, several philosophers have offered sophisticated arguments to support the view that moral standing should be extended to include animals (see Animals and Ethics).

Peter Singer and Tom Regan are the most famous proponents of the view that we should extend moral standing to other species of animal. While both develop quite different animal ethics, their reasons for according moral status to animals are fairly similar. According to Singer, the criterion for moral standing is sentience: the capacity to feel pleasure and pain (Singer, 1974). For Regan, on the other hand, moral standing should be acknowledged in all “subjects-of-a-life”: that is, those beings with beliefs, desires, perception, memory, emotions, a sense of future and the ability to initiate action (Regan, 1983/2004, ch. 7). So, while Regan and Singer give slightly different criteria for moral standing, both place a premium on a form of consciousness.

For Singer, if an entity possesses the relevant type of consciousness, then that entity should be given equal consideration when we formulate our moral obligations. Note that the point is not that every sentient being should be treated equally, but that it should be considered equally. In other words, the differences between individuals, and thus their different interests, should be taken into account. Thus, for Singer it would not be wrong to deny pigs the vote, for obviously pigs have no interest in participating in a democratic society; but it would be wrong to subordinate pigs’ interest in not suffering, for clearly pigs have a strong interest in avoiding pain, just like us. Singer then feeds his principle of equal consideration into a utilitarian ethical framework, whereby the ultimate moral goal is to bring about the greatest possible satisfaction of interests. So there are two strands to Singer’s theory: first of all, we must consider the interests of sentient beings equally; and secondly, our obligations are founded on the aim of bringing about the greatest amount of interest-satisfaction that we can.

Tom Regan takes issue with Singer’s utilitarian ethical framework, and uses the criterion of consciousness to build a “rights-based” theory. For Regan, all entities who are “subjects-of-a-life” possess “inherent value”. This means that such entities have a value of their own, irrespective of their good for other beings or their contribution to some ultimate ethical norm. In effect then, Regan proposes that there are moral limits to what one can do to a subject-of-a-life. This position stands in contrast to Singer who feeds all interests into the utilitarian calculus and bases our moral obligations on what satisfies the greatest number. Thus, in Singer’s view it might be legitimate to sacrifice the interests of certain individuals for the sake of the interest-satisfaction of others. For example, imagine that it is proven that a particular set of painful experiments on half a dozen pigs will lead to the discovery of some new medicine that will itself alleviate the pain of a few dozen human beings (or other sentient animals). If one’s ultimate norm is to satisfy the maximum number of interests, then such experiments should take place. However, for Regan there are moral limits to what one can do to an entity with inherent value, irrespective of these overall consequences. These moral limits are “rights”, and are possessed by all creatures who are subjects-of-a-life.

But what does all this have to do with environmental ethics? Well, in one obvious sense animal welfare is relevant to environmental ethics because animals exist within the natural environment and thus form part of environmentalists’ concerns. However, extending moral standing to animals also leads to the formulation of particular types of environmental obligations. Essentially, these ethics claim that when we consider how our actions impact on the environment, we should not just evaluate how these affect humans (present and/or future), but also how they affect the interests and rights of animals (Singer, 1993, ch. 10, and Regan, 1983/2004, ch. 9). For example, even if clearing an area of forest were proven to be of benefit to humans both in the short and long-term, that would not be the end of the matter as far as animal ethics are concerned. The welfare of the animals residing within and around the forest must also be considered.

However, many environmental philosophers have been dissatisfied with these kinds of animal-centered environmental ethics. Indeed, some have claimed that animal liberation cannot even be considered a legitimate environmental ethic (Callicott, 1980, Sagoff, 1984). For these thinkers, all animal-centered ethics suffer from two fundamental and devastating problems: first of all, they are too narrowly individualistic; and secondly, the logic of animal ethics implies unjustifiable interference with natural processes. As for the first point, it is pointed out that our concerns for the environment extend beyond merely worrying about individual creatures. Rather, for environmentalists, “holistic” entities matter, such as species and ecosystems. Moreover, sometimes the needs of a “whole” clash with the interests of the individuals that comprise it. Indeed, the over-abundance of individuals of a particular species of animal can pose a serious threat to the normal functioning of an ecosystem. For example, many of us will be familiar with the problems rabbits have caused to ecosystems in Australia. Thus, for many environmentalists, we have an obligation to kill these damaging animals. Clearly, this stands opposed to the conclusions of an ethic that gives such weight to the interests and rights of individual animals. The individualistic nature of an animal-centered ethic also means that it faces difficulty in explaining our concern for the plight of endangered species. After all, if individual conscious entities are all that matter morally, then the last surviving panda must be owed just the same as my pet cat. For many environmental philosophers this is simply wrong, and priority must be given to the endangered species (Rolston III, 1985).

Animal-centered ethics also face attack for some of the implications of their arguments. For example, if we have obligations to alleviate the suffering of animals, as these authors suggest, does that mean we must stop predator animals from killing their prey, or partition off prey animals so that they are protected from such attacks (Sagoff, 1984)? Such conclusions not only seem absurd, but also inimical to the environmentalist goal of preserving natural habitats and processes.

Having said all of this, I should not over-emphasize the opposition between animal ethics and environmental ethics. Just because animal ethicists grant moral standing only to conscious individuals, that does not mean that they hold everything else in contempt (Jamieson, 1998). Holistic entities may not have independent moral standing, according to these thinkers, but that does not equate to ignoring them. After all, the welfare and interests of individual entities are often bound up with the healthy functioning of the “wholes” that they make up. Moreover, the idea that animal ethics imply large-scale interferences in the environment can be questioned when one considers how much harm this would inflict upon predator and scavenger animals. Nevertheless, clashes of interest between individual animals and other natural entities are inevitable, and when push comes to shove animal ethicists will invariably grant priority to individual conscious animals. Many environmental ethicists disagree, and are convinced that the boundaries of our ethical concern need to be pushed back further.

c. Individual Living Organisms

As noted above, numerous philosophers have questioned the notion that only conscious beings have moral standing. Some have done this by proposing a thought experiment based on a “last-human scenario” (Attfield, 1983, p. 155). The thought experiment asks us to consider a situation, such as the aftermath of a nuclear holocaust, where the only surviving human being is faced with the only surviving tree of its species. If the individual chops down the tree, no human would be harmed by its destruction. For our purposes we should alter the example and say that all animals have also perished in the holocaust. If this amendment is made, we can go further and say that no conscious being would be harmed by the tree’s destruction. Would this individual be wrong to destroy the tree? According to a human or animal-centered ethic, it is hard to see why such destruction would be wrong. And yet, many of us have the strong intuition that the individual would act wrongly by chopping down the tree. For some environmental philosophers, this intuition suggests that moral standing should be extended beyond conscious life to include individual living organisms, such as trees.

Of course, and as I have mentioned before, we cannot rely only on intuitions to decide who or what has moral standing. For this reason, a number of philosophers have come up with arguments to justify assigning moral standing to individual living organisms. One of the earliest philosophers to put forward such an argument was Albert Schweitzer. Schweitzer’s influential “Reverence for Life” ethic claims that all living things have a “will to live”, and that humans should not interfere with or extinguish this will (Schweitzer, 1923). But while it is clear that living organisms struggle for survival, it is simply not true that they “will” to live. This, after all, would require some kind of conscious experience, which many living things lack. However, perhaps what Schweitzer was getting at was something like Paul W. Taylor’s more recent claim that all living things are “teleological centers of life” (Taylor, 1986). For Taylor, this means that living things have a good of their own that they strive towards, even if they lack awareness of this fact. This good, according to Taylor, is the full development of an organism’s biological powers. In similar arguments to Regan’s, Taylor claims that because living organisms have a good of their own, they have inherent value; that is, value for their own sake, irrespective of their value to other beings. It is this value that grants individual living organisms moral status, and means that we must take the interests and needs of such entities into account when formulating our moral obligations.

But if we recognize moral standing in every living thing, how are we then to formulate any meaningful moral obligations? After all, don’t we as humans require the destruction of many living organisms simply in order to live? For example we need to walk, eat, shelter and clothe ourselves, all of which will usually involve harming living things. Schweitzer’s answer is that we can only harm or end the life of a living entity when absolutely necessary. Of course, this simply begs the question: when is absolutely necessary? Taylor attempts to answer this question by advocating a position of general equality between the interests of living things, together with a series of principles in the event of clashes of interest. First, the principles state that humans are allowed to act in self-defense to prevent harm being inflicted by other living organisms. Second, the basic interests of nonhuman living entities should take priority over the nonbasic or trivial interests of humans. Third, when basic interests clash, humans are not required to sacrifice themselves for the sake of others (Taylor, 1986, pp. 264-304).

As several philosophers have pointed out, however, this ethic is still incredibly demanding. For example, because my interest in having a pretty garden is nonbasic, and a weed’s interest in survival is basic, I am forbidden from pulling it out according to Taylor’s ethical framework. For some, this makes the ethic unreasonably burdensome. No doubt because of these worries, other philosophers who accord moral standing to all living organisms have taken a rather different stance. Instead of adopting an egalitarian position on the interests of living things, they propose a hierarchical framework (Attfield, 1983 and Varner, 1998). Such thinkers point out that moral standing is not the same as moral significance. So while we could acknowledge that plants have moral standing, we might nevertheless accord them a much lower significance than human beings, thus making it easier to justify our use and destruction of them. Nevertheless, several philosophers remain uneasy about the construction of such hierarchies and wonder whether it negates the acknowledgement of moral standing in the first place. After all, if we accept such a hierarchy, just how low is the moral significance of plants? If it is low enough so that I can eat them, weed them and walk on them, what is the point of granting them any moral standing at all?

There remain two crucial challenges facing philosophers who attribute moral standing to individual living organisms that have not yet been addressed. One challenge comes from the anthropocentric thinkers and animal liberationists. They deny that “being alive” is a sufficient condition for the possession of moral standing. For example, while plants may have a biological good, is it really good of their own? Indeed, there seems to be no sense in which something can be said to be good or bad from the point of view of the plant itself. And if the plant doesn’t care about its fate, why should we (Warren, 2000, p. 48)? In response to this challenge, environmental ethicists have pointed out that conscious volition of an object or state is not necessary for that object or state to be a good. For example, consider a cat that needs worming. It is very unlikely that the cat has any understanding of what worming is, or that he needs worming in order to remain healthy and fit. However, it makes perfect sense to say that worming is good for the cat, because it contributes to the cat’s functioning and flourishing. Similarly, plants and tress may not consciously desire sunlight, water or nutrition, but each, according to some ethicists, can be said to be good for them in that they contribute to their biological flourishing.

The second challenge comes from philosophers who question the individualistic nature of these particular ethics. As mentioned above, these critics do not believe that an environmental ethic should place such a high premium on individuals. For many, this individualistic stance negates important ecological commitments to the interdependence of living things, and the harmony to be found in natural processes. Moreover, it is alleged that these individualistic ethics suffer from the same faults as anthropocentric and animal-centered ethics: they simply cannot account for our real and demanding obligations to holistic entities such as species and ecosystems. Once again, however, a word of caution is warranted here. It is not the case that philosophers who ascribe moral standing to individual living things simply ignore the importance of such “wholes”. Often the equilibrium of these entities is taken extremely seriously (See Taylor, 1986, p. 77). However, it must be remembered that such concern is extended only insofar as such equilibrium is necessary in order for individual living organisms to flourish; the wholes themselves have no independent moral standing. In the next section, those philosophers who claim that this standing should be extended to such “wholes” will be examined.

d. Holistic Entities

While Albert Schweitzer can be regarded as the most prominent philosophical influence for thinkers who grant moral standing to all individual living things, Aldo Leopold is undoubtedly the main influence on those who propose “holistic” ethics. Aldo Leopold’s “land ethic” demands that we stop treating the land as a mere object or resource. For Leopold, land is not merely soil. Instead, land is a fountain of energy, flowing through a circuit of soils, plants and animals. While food chains conduct the energy upwards from the soil, death and decay returns the energy back to the soil. Thus, the flow of energy relies on a complex structure of relations between living things. While evolution gradually changes these relations, Leopold argues that man’s interventions have been much more violent and destructive. In order to preserve the relations within the land, Leopold claims that we must move towards a “land ethic”, thereby granting moral standing to the land community itself, not just its individual members. This culminates in Leopold’s famous ethical injunction: “A thing is right when it tends to preserve the integrity, stability, and beauty of the biotic community. It is wrong when it tends otherwise” (Leopold, 1949/1989, pp. 218-225).

Several philosophers, however, have questioned Leopold’s justification of the land ethic. For one thing, it seems that Leopold jumps too quickly from a descriptive account of how the land is, to a prescriptive account of what we ought to do. In other words, even if Leopold’s accounts of the land and its energy flows are correct, why should we preserve it? What precisely is it about the biotic community that makes it deserving of moral standing? Unfortunately, Leopold seems to offer no answers to these important questions, and thus no reason to build our environmental obligations around his land ethic. However, J. Baird Callicott has argued that such criticisms of Leopold are unfair and misplaced. According to Callicott, Leopold lies outside of mainstream moral theory. Rather than assign moral standing on the identification of some particular characteristic, such as consciousness or a biological good of one’s own, Leopold is claimed to accord moral standing on the basis of moral sentiment and affection. Thus, the question is not, what quality does the land possess that makes it worthy of moral standing? But rather, how do we feel about the land (Callicott, 1998)? In this light, the land ethic can be seen as an injunction to broaden our moral sentiments beyond self-interest, and beyond humanity to include the whole biotic community. This, so the argument goes, bridges the gap between the descriptive and the prescriptive in Leopold’s thought.

Of course, some have questioned whether sentiment and feelings are suitable foundations for an environmental ethic. After all, there seem to be plenty of people out there who have no affection for the biotic community whatsoever. If Leopold’s injunction is ignored by such people, must we simply give up hope of formulating any environmental obligations? In the search for more concrete foundations, Lawrence E. Johnson has built an alternative case for according moral standing to holistic entities (Johnson, 1993). Johnson claims that once we recognize that interests are not always tied to conscious experience, the door is opened to the possibility of nonconscious entities having interests and thus moral standing. So, just as breathing oxygen is in the interests of a child, even though the child has neither a conscious desire for oxygen, nor any understanding of what oxygen is, so do species have an interest in fulfilling their nature. This is because both have a good of their own, based on the integrated functioning of their life processes (ibid., p. 142). Children can flourish as living things, and so too can species and ecosystems; so, according to Johnson, both have interests that must be taken into account in our ethical deliberations.

But even if we accept that moral standing should be extended to holistic entities on this basis, we still need to consider how we are then to flesh out our moral obligations concerning the environment. For some, this is where holistic ethics fail to convince. In particular, it has been claimed that holistic ethics condone sacrificing individuals for the sake of the whole. Now while many holistic philosophers do explicitly condone sacrificing individuals in some situations, for example by shooting rabbits to preserve plant species, they are reluctant to sacrifice human interests in similar situations. But isn’t the most abundant species destroying biotic communities Homo sapiens? And if human individuals are just another element within the larger and more important biotic community, is it not necessary under holistic ethics to kill some of these “human pests” for the sake of the larger whole? Such considerations have led Tom Regan to label the implications of holistic ethics as “environmental fascism” (Regan, 1983/2004, p. 362). In response, proponents of such ethics have claimed that acknowledging moral standing in holistic entities does not mean that one must deny the interests and rights of human beings. They claim that granting moral standing to “wholes” is not the same thing as taking it away from individuals. While this is obviously true, that still leaves the question of what to do when the interests of wholes clash with the interests of individuals. If humans cannot be sacrificed for the good of the whole, why can rabbits?

The answer that has been put forward by Callicott claims that while the biotic community matters morally, it is not the only community that matters. Rather, we are part of various “nested” communities all of which have claims upon us. Thus, our obligations to the biotic community may require the culling of rabbits, but may not require the culling of humans. This is because we are part of a tight-knit human community, but only a very loose human-rabbit community. In this way, we can adjudicate clashes of interest, based on our community commitments. This communitarian proposal certainly seems a way out of the dilemma. Unfortunately, it faces two key problems: first, just who decides the content and strength of our various community commitments; and second, if human relationships are the closest, does all this lead back to anthropocentrism? As for the first point, if deciding on our community attachments is left up to individuals themselves, this will lead to quite diverse and even repugnant moral obligations. For example, if an individual believes that he has a much stronger attachment to white males than to black women, does this mean that he can legitimately favor the interests of the former over the latter? If not, and an objective standard is to be imposed, we are left with the enormous problem of discovering this standard and reaching consensus on it. Secondly, if our moral commitments to the biotic community are trumped by our obligations to the human community, doesn’t this lead us back down the path to anthropocentrism – the very thing the holist wants to avoid?

Without doubt, extending moral standing to the degree of holistic ethics requires some extremely careful argumentation when it comes to working out the precise content of our environmental obligations.

2. Radical Ecology

Not all philosophers writing on our obligations concerning the environment see the problem simply in terms of extending moral standing. Instead, many thinkers regard environmental concerns to have warranted an entirely new ideological perspective that has been termed, after its biological counterpart, “ecology”. While the ideas and beliefs within this “radical ecology” movement are diverse, they possess two common elements that separates them from the ethical extensionism outlined above. First of all, none see extending moral standing as sufficient to resolve the environmental crisis. They argue that a broader philosophical perspective is needed, requiring fundamental changes in both our attitude to and understanding of reality. This involves reexamining who we are as human beings and our place within the natural world. For radical ecologists, ethical extensionism is inadequate because it is stuck in the traditional ways of thinking that led to these environmental problems in the first place. In short, it is argued that ethical extensionism remains too human-centered, because it takes human beings as the paradigm examples of entities with moral standing and then extends outwards to those things considered sufficiently similar. Secondly, none of these radical ecologies confine themselves solely to the arena of ethics. Instead, radical ecologies also demand fundamental changes in society and its institutions. In other words, these ideologies have a distinctively political element, requiring us to confront the environmental crisis by changing the very way we live and function, both as a society and as individuals.

a. Deep Ecology

Deep ecology is perhaps most easily understood when considered in opposition to its “shallow” counterpart. According to deep ecologists, shallow ecology is anthropocentric and concerned with pollution and resource depletion. Shallow ecology might thus be regarded as very much the mainstream wing of environmentalism. Deep ecology, in contrast, rejects anthropocentrism and takes a “total-field” perspective. In other words, deep ecologists are not aiming to formulate moral principles concerning the environment to supplement our existing ethical framework. Instead, they demand an entirely new worldview and philosophical perspective. According to Arne Naess, the Norwegian philosopher who first outlined this shallow-deep split in environmentalism, deep ecologists advocate the development of a new eco-philosophy or “ecosophy“ to replace the destructive philosophy of modern industrial society (Naess, 1973). While the various eco-philosophies that have developed within deep ecology are diverse, Naess and George Sessions have compiled a list of eight principles or statements that are basic to deep ecology:

The well-being and flourishing of human and non-human life on Earth have value in themselves (synonyms: intrinsic value, inherent worth). These values are independent of the usefulness of the non-human world for human purposes.
Richness and diversity of life forms contribute to the realization of these values and are also values in themselves.
Humans have no right to reduce this richness and diversity except to satisfy vital needs.
The flourishing of human life and cultures is compatible with a substantially smaller population. The flourishing of non-human life requiresa smaller human population.
Present human interference with the non-human world is excessive, and the situation is rapidly worsening.
Policies must therefore be changed. These policies affect basic economic, technological and ideological structures. The resulting state of affairs will be deeply different from the present.
The ideological change will be mainly that of appreciating life quality (dwelling in situations of inherent value) rather than adhering to an increasingly higher standard of living. There will be a profound awareness of the difference between bigness and greatness.
Those who subscribe to the foregoing points have an obligation directly or indirectly to try to implement the necessary changes (Naess, 1986).

But while Naess regards those who subscribe to these statements as supporters of deep ecology, he does not believe it to follow that all such supporters will have the same worldview or “ecosophy”. In other words deep ecologists do not offer one unified ultimate perspective, but possess various and divergent philosophical and religious allegiances.

Naess’s own ecosophy involves just one fundamental ethical norm: “Self-realization!” For Naess, this norm involves giving up a narrow egoistic conception of the self in favor of a wider more comprehensive Self (hence the deliberate capital “S”). Moving to this wider Self involves recognizing that as human beings we are not removed from nature, but are interconnected with it. Recognizing our wider Self thus involves identifying ourselves with all other life forms on the planet. The Australian philosopher Warwick Fox has taken up this theme of self-realization in his own eco-philosophy, “transpersonal ecology”. Fox does not regard environmental ethics to be predominantly about formulating our moral obligations concerning the environment, but instead views it as about the realization of an “ecological consciousness”. For Fox, as with Naess, this consciousness involves our widest possible identification with the non-human world. The usual ethical concern of formulating principles and obligations thus becomes unnecessary, according to Fox, for once the appropriate consciousness is established, one will naturally protect the environment and allow it to flourish, for that will be part and parcel of the protection and flourishing of oneself (Fox,1990).

Critics of deep ecology argue that it is just too vague to address real environmental concerns. For one thing, in its refusal to reject so many worldviews and philosophical perspectives, many have claimed that it is difficult to uncover just what deep ecology advocates. For example, on the one hand, Naess offers us eight principles that deep ecologists should accept, and on the other he claims that deep ecology is not about drawing up codes of conduct, but adopting a global comprehensive attitude. Now, if establishing principles is important, as so many ethicists believe, perhaps deep ecology requires more precision than can be found in Naess and Sessions’s platform. In particular, just how are we to deal with clashes of interests? According to the third principle, for example, humans have no right to reduce the richness and diversity of the natural world unless to meet vital needs. But does that mean we are under an obligation to protect the richness and diversity of the natural world? If so, perhaps we could cull non-native species such as rabbits when they damage ecosystems. But then, the first principle states that non-human beings such as rabbits have inherent value, and the fifth principle states that human interference in nature is already excessive. So just what should we do? Clearly, the principles as stated by Naess and Sessions are too vague to offer any real guide for action.

However, perhaps principles are not important, as both Naess and Fox have claimed. Instead, they claim that we must rely on the fostering of the appropriate states of consciousness. Unfortunately, two problems remain. First of all, it is not at all clear that all conflicts of interest will be resolved by the adoption of the appropriate state of consciousness. For even if I identify myself with all living things, some of those things, such as bacteria and viruses, may still threaten me as a discrete living organism. And if conflicts of interest remain, don’t we need principles to resolve them? Secondly, and as we saw with Leopold’s land ethic, just what are we to do about those who remain unconvinced about adopting this new state of consciousness? If there aren’t any rational arguments, principles or obligations to point to, what chance is there of persuading such people to take the environmental crisis seriously?

At this point deep ecologists would object that such criticisms remain rooted in the ideology that has caused so much of the crisis we now face. For example, take the point about persuading others. Deep ecologists claim that argument and debate are not the only means we must use to help people realize their ecological consciousness; we must also use such things as poetry, music and art. This relates back to the point I made at the beginning of the section: deep ecologists do not call for supplementary moral principles concerning the environment, but an entirely new worldview. Whether such a radical shift in the way we think about ourselves and the environment is possible, remains to be seen.

b. Social Ecology

Social ecology shares with deep ecology the view that the foundations of the environmental crisis lie in the dominant ideology of modern western societies. Thus, just as with deep ecology, social ecology claims that in order to resolve the crisis, a radical overhaul of this ideology is necessary. However, the new ideology that social ecology proposes is not concerned with the “self-realization” of deep ecology, but instead the absence of domination. Indeed, domination is the key theme in the writings of Murray Bookchin, the most prominent social ecologist. For Bookchin, environmental problems are directly related to social problems. In particular, Bookchin claims that the hierarchies of power prevalent within modern societies have fostered a hierarchical relationship between humans and the natural world (Bookchin, 1982). Indeed, it is the ideology of the free market that has facilitated such hierarchies, reducing both human beings and the natural world to mere commodities. Bookchin argues that the liberation of both humans and nature are actually dependent on one another. Thus his argument is quite different from Marxist thought, in which man’s freedom is dependent on the complete domination of the natural world through technology. For Bookchin and other social ecologists, this Marxist thinking involves the same fragmentation of humans from nature that is prevalent in capitalist ideology. Instead, it is argued that humans must recognize that they are part of nature, not distinct or separate from it. In turn then, human societies and human relations with nature can be informed by the non-hierarchical relations found within the natural world. For example, Bookchin points out that within an ecosystem, there is no species more important than another, instead relationships are mutualistic and interrelated. This interdependence and lack of hierarchy in nature, it is claimed, provides a blueprint for a non-hierarchical human society (Bookchin, 2001).

Without doubt, the transformation that Bookchin calls for is radical. But just what will this new non-hierarchical, interrelated and mutualistic human society look like? For Bookchin, an all powerful centralized state is just another agent for domination. Thus in order to truly be rid of hierarchy, the transformation must take place within smaller local communities. Such communities will be based on sustainable agriculture, participation through democracy, and of course freedom through non-domination. Not only then does nature help cement richer and more equal human communities, but transformed societies also foster a more benign relationship with nature. This latter point illustrates Bookchin’s optimistic view of humanity’s potential. After all, Bookchin does not think that we should condemn all of humanity for causing the ecological crisis, for instead it is the relationships within societies that are to blame (Bookchin, 1991). Because of this, Bookchin is extremely critical of the anti-humanism and misanthropy he perceives to be prevalent in much deep ecology.

One problem that has been identified with Bookchin’s social ecology is his extrapolation from the natural world to human society. Bookchin argues that the interdependence and lack of hierarchy within nature provides a grounding for non-hierarchical human societies. However, as we saw when discussing Aldo Leopold, it is one thing to say how nature is, but quite another to say how society ought to be. Even if we accept that there are no natural hierarchies within nature (which for many is dubious), there are plenty of other aspects of it that most of us would not want to foster in our human society. For example, weak individuals and weak species are often killed, eaten and out-competed in an ecosystem. This, of course, is perfectly natural and even fits in with ecology’s characterization of nature as interconnected. However, should this ground human societies in which the weak are killed, eaten and out-competed? Most of us find such a suggestion repugnant. Following this type of reasoning, many thinkers have warned of the dangers of drawing inferences about how society should be organized from certain facts about how nature is (Dobson, 1995, p. 42).

Some environmental philosophers have also pointed to a second problem with Bookchin’s theory. For many, his social ecology is anthropocentric, thus failing to grant the environment the standing it deserves. Critics cite evidence of anthropocentrism in the way Bookchin accounts for the liberation of both humans and nature. This unfolding process will not just occur of its own accord, according to Bookchin, rather, human beings must facilitate it. Of course, many philosophers are extremely skeptical of the very idea that history is inevitably “unfolding” towards some particular direction. However, some environmental philosophers are more wary of the prominent place that Bookchin gives to human beings in facilitating this unfolding. Of course, to what extent this is a problem depends on one’s point of view. After all, if humans cannot ameliorate the environmental problems we face, is there much point doing environmental ethics in the first place? Indeed, Bookchin himself has been rather nonplussed by this charge, and explicitly denies that humans are just another community in nature. But he also denies that nature exists solely for the purposes of humans. However, the critics remain unconvinced, and believe it to be extremely arrogant to think that humans know what the unfolding of nature will look like, let alone to think that they can bring it about (Eckersley, 1992, pp. 154-156).

c. Ecofeminism

Like social ecology, ecofeminism also points to a link between social domination and the domination of the natural world. And like both deep ecology and social ecology, ecofeminism calls for a radical overhaul of the prevailing philosophical perspective and ideology of western society. However, ecofeminism is a broad church, and there are actually a number of different positions that feminist writers on the environment have taken. In this section I will review three of the most prominent.

Val Plumwood offers a critique of the rationalism inherent in traditional ethics and blames this rationalism for the oppression of both women and nature. The fundamental problem with rationalism, so Plumwood claims, is its fostering of dualisms. For example, reason itself is usually presented in stark opposition to emotion. Traditional ethics, Plumwood argues, promote reason as capable of providing a stable foundation for moral argument, because of its impartiality and universalizability. Emotion, on the other hand, lacks these characteristics, and because it is based on sentiment and affection makes for shaky ethical frameworks. Plumwood claims that this dualism between reason and emotion grounds other dualisms in rationalist thought: in particular, mind/body, human/nature and man/woman. In each case, the former is held to be superior to the latter (Plumwood, 1991). So, for Plumwood, the inferiority of both women and nature have a common source: namely, rationalism. Once this is recognized, so the argument goes, it becomes clear that simple ethical extensionism as outlined above is insufficient to resolve the domination of women and nature. After all, such extensionism is stuck in the same mainstream rationalist thought that is the very source of the problem. What is needed instead, according to Plumwood, is a challenge to rationalism itself, and thus a challenge to the dualisms it perpetuates.

However, while it is perfectly possible to acknowledge the rationalism present in much mainstream ethical thinking, one can nevertheless query Plumwood’s characterization of it. After all, does rationalism necessarily

promote dualisms that are responsible for the subjugation of women and nature? Such a claim would seem odd given the many rationalist arguments that have been put forward to promote the rights and interests of both women and the natural world. In addition, many thinkers would argue that rationalist thought is not the enemy, but instead the best hope for securing proper concern for the environment and for women. For as we have seen above, such thinkers believe that relying on the sentiments and feelings of individuals is too unstable a foundation upon which to ground a meaningful ethical framework.

Karen J. Warren has argued that the dualisms of rationalist thought, as outlined by Plumwood, are not in themselves problematic. Rather, Warren claims that they become problematic when they are used in conjunction with an “oppressive conceptual framework” to justifysubordination. Warren argues that one feature inherent within an oppressive conceptual framework is the “logic of domination”. Thus, a list of the differences between humans and nature, and between men and women, is not in itself harmful. But once assumptions are added, such as these differences leading to the moral superiority

of humans and of men, then we move closer to the claim that we are justified in subordinating women and nature on the basis of their inferiority. According to Warren, just such a logic of domination has been prevalent within western society. Men have been identified with the realm of the “mental” and “human”, while women have been identified with the “physical” and the “natural”. Once it is claimed that the “natural” and the “physical” are morally inferior to the “human” and “mental”, men become justified in subordinating women and nature. For Warren then, feminists and environmentalists share the same goal: namely, to abolish this oppressive conceptual framework (Warren, 1990).

Other ecofeminists take a quite different approach to Plumwood and Warren. Rather than outlining the connections between the domination

of women and of nature, they instead emphasize those things that link women and the natural world. Women, so the argument goes, stand in a much closer relationship to the natural world due to their capacity for child-bearing. For some ecofeminists, this gives women a unique perspective on how to build harmonious relationships with the natural world. Indeed, many such thinkers advocate a spiritualist approach in which nature and the land are given a sacred value, harking back to ancient religions in which the Earth is considered female (Mies & Shiva, 1993).

For writers such as Plumwood, however, emphasizing women’s “naturalness” in this way simply reinforces the dualism that led to women’s oppression in the first place. Placing women as closer to nature, according to Plumwood, simply places them closer to oppression. Other critics argue that the adoption of a spiritualist approach leads feminists to turn their attention inwards to themselves and their souls, and away from those individuals and entities they should be trying to liberate. However, in response, these ecofeminists may make the same point as the deep ecologists: to resolve the environmental problems we face, and the systems of domination in place, it is the consciousness and philosophical outlook of individuals that must change.

3. The Future of Environmental Ethics

Given the increasing concern for the environment and the impact that our actions have upon it, it is clear that the field of environmental ethics is here to stay.

However, it is less clear in what way the discipline will move forward. Having said that,

there is evidence for at least three future developments. First of all, environmental ethics needs to be and will be informed by changes in the political efforts to ameliorate environmental problems. Environmental ethics concerns formulating our moral obligations regarding the environment. While this enterprise can be, and often is, quite abstract, it is also meant to engage with the real world. After all, ethicists are making claims about how they think the world ought to be. Given this, the effectiveness of states and governments in “getting there” will affect the types of ethics that emerge. For example, the Kyoto Protocol might be regarded as the first real global attempt to deal with the problem of climate change. However, without the participation of so many large polluters, with the agreed reductions in greenhouse gas emissions so small, and with many countries looking like they may well miss their targets, many commentators already regard it as a failure. Ethicists need to respond not just by castigating those they blame for the failure. Rather they must propose alternative and better means of resolving the problems we face. For example, is it more important to outline a scheme of obligations for individuals

rather than states, and go for a bottom-up solution to these problems? Alternatively, perhaps businesses

should take the lead in tackling these problems. Indeed, it may even be in the interests of big business to be active in this way, given the power of consumers. It is quite possible then, that we will see business ethics address many of the same issues that environmental ethics has been tackling.

However, the effects of environmental ethics will not be limited to influencing and informing business ethics alone, but will undoubtedly feed into and merge with more mainstream ethical thinking.

After all, the environment is not something one can remove oneself from. In light of this, once it is recognized that we have environmental obligations, all areas of ethics are affected, including just war theory, domestic distributive justice, global distributive justice, human rights theory and many others. Take global distributive justice as an example: if one considers how climate change will affect people throughout the world so differently – affecting individuals’ homes, sanitation, resistance from disease, ability to earn a living and so on – it is clear that consideration of the environment is essential to such questions of justice. Part of the job of the environmental ethicist will thus be to give such disciplines the benefit of his or her expertise.

Finally, environmental ethics will of course be informed by our scientific understanding of the environment. Whether it be changes in our understanding of how ecosystems work, or changes in the evidence concerning the environmental crisis, it is clear that such change will inform and influence those thinkers writing on our environmental obligations.

4. References and Further Reading

Attfield, Robin, The Ethics of Environmental Concern (Oxford: Basil Blackwell, 1983).
Barry, Brian, “Sustainability and Intergenerational Justice” in Dobson, Andrew (ed.), Fairness and Futurity (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1999): 93-117.
Benson, John, Environmental Ethics: An Introduction with Readings (London: Routledge, 2001).
Blackstone, William T., “Ethics and Ecology” in Blackstone, William T. (ed.), Philosophy and Environmental Crisis (Athens, University of Georgia Press, 1972): 16-42.
Bookchin, Murray, The Ecology of Freedom: The Emergence and Dissolution of Hierarchy (Palo Alto, CA: Cheshire Books, 1982).
Bookchin, Murray, “What is Social Ecology?” in, Boylan, Michael (ed.), Environmental Ethics (New Jersey: Prentice Hall, 2001): 62-76.
Bookchin, Murray and Foreman, Dave, Defending the Earth (New York: Black Rose Books, 1991).
Boylan, Michael (ed.), Environmental Ethics (New Jersey: Prentice Hall, 2001).
Brennan, Andrew and Lo, Yeuk-Sze, “Environmental Ethics”, The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Summer 2002 Edition), Edward N. Zalta (ed.), http://plato.stanford.edu/archives/sum2002/entries/ethics-environmental.
Callicott, James Baird, “Animal Liberation: A Triangular Affair”, Environmental Ethics 2 (1980): 311-328.
Callicott, James Baird, “The Conceptual Foundations of the Land Ethic” in Zimmerman, Michael E.; Callicott, J. Baird; Sessions, George; Warren, Karen J.; and Clark, John (eds.), Environmental Philosophy: From Animal Rights to Radical Ecology (New Jersey: Prentice Hall, 2^nd ed., 1998): 101-123.
Carson, Rachel, Silent Spring (Boston: Houghton Mifflin, 1962).
DesJardins, Joseph R., Environmental Ethics: An Introduction to Environmental Philosophy (Belmont CA: Wadsworth, 3^rd ed., 2001).
Dobson, Andrew, Green Political Thought (London: Routledge, 2^nd ed., 1995).
Eckersely, Robyn, Environmentalism and Political Theory: Toward an Ecocentric Approach (London: UCL Press, 1992).
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Author Information

Alasdair Cochrane
Email: A.D.Cochrane@lse.ac.uk
London School of Economics and Political Science
United Kingdom

Process Philosophy

Process philosophy is a longstanding philosophical tradition that emphasizes becoming and changing over static being. Though present in many historical and cultural periods, the term “process philosophy” is primarily associated with the work of the philosophers Alfred North Whitehead (1861-1947) and Charles Hartshorne (1897-2000).

Process philosophy is characterized by an attempt to reconcile the diverse intuitions found in human experience (such as religious, scientific, and aesthetic) into a coherent holistic scheme. Process philosophy seeks a return to a neo-classical realism that avoids subjectivism. This reconciliation of the intuitions of objectivity and subjectivity, with a concern for scientific findings, produces the explicitly metaphysical speculation that the world, at its most fundamental level, is made up of momentary events of experience rather than enduring material substances. Process philosophy speculates that these momentary events, called “actual occasions” or “actual entities,” are essentially self-determining, experiential, and internally related to each other.

Actual occasions correspond to electrons and sub-atomic particles, but also to human persons. The human person is a society of billions of these occasions (that is, the body), which is organized and coordinated by a single dominant occasion (that is, the mind). Thus, process philosophy avoids a strict mind-body dualism.

Most process philosophers speculate that God is also an actual entity, though there is an internal debate among process thinkers whether God is a series of momentary actual occasions, like other worldly societies, or a single everlasting and constantly developing actual entity. Either way, process philosophy conceives of God as dipolar. God’s primordial nature is the permanent ground of value and determinacy and a storehouse for universals, or “envisaged potentialities.” God’s consequent nature, on the other hand, takes in data from the world at every instant, changing as the world changes. A considerable number of process philosophers argue that God is not a necessary element of the metaphysical system and may be excised from the process model without any loss of consistency.

Process philosophy has also been cited as a unique synthesis of classical methodology, modern concerns for scientific adequacy, and post-modern critiques of hegemony, dualism, determinism, materialism, and egocentrism. In this respect, process philosophy is sometimes called “constructive postmodernism,” alluding to its speculative method of system building with a hypothetical and fallible stance, over the alternative of deconstruction.

What Counts as Process Philosophy
1. The Perennial Process Tradition
2. The Whitehead-Hartshorne Tradition
Assumptions and Method
Basic Metaphysics
The Human Person
1. Panexperientialism with Organizational Duality
2. Perception and Prehension
God and the World
1. Dipolar Panentheism
2. Freedom and the Problem of Evil
Non-theistic Variations
Process Philosophy as Constructive Postmodernism
Conclusion
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources
2. Secondary Sources

1. What Counts as Process Philosophy

a. The Perennial Process Tradition

Process philosophy argues that the language of development and change are more appropriate descriptors of reality than the language of static being. This tradition has roots in the West in the pre-Socratic Heraclitus, who likened the structure of reality to the element of fire, as change is reality and stability is illusion. Heraclitus is famous for the aphorism that one can never step in the same river twice.

In Eastern traditions, many Taoist and Buddhist doctrines can be classified as “process.” For example, the Taoist admonition that one should be spontaneously receptive to the never ending flux of yin and yang emphasizes a process worldview, as do the Buddhist notions of pratyitya-samutpada (the inter-dependent origination of events) and anatma (the denial of a substantial or enduring self).

More recently on the continent, one finds process philosophers in Hegel, who saw the history of the world as processive and dialectic unfolding of Absolute Spirit and in Gottfried Leibniz, Henri Bergson, Nikolai Berdyaev, Friedrich Nietzsche, and Pierre Teilhard de Chardin. Even David Hume (insofar as he rejected the idea of a substantial self in favor of a series of unconnected perceptual “bundles”) can be considered a process philosopher.

Process Philosophy found its most fertile ground and active development in 20th century North America. American philosophers Samuel Alexander, George Herbert Mead, John Dewey, C.S. Peirce, William James, Alfred North Whitehead, Charles Hartshorne, and others continue this tradition.

Peirce’s philosophy is process-oriented in several respects. He defines truth as the unattainable goal of a never-ending process of inquiry. Likewise, Peirce’s semiology indicates that the meaning of signs is always triangulated between an object, its sign, and the infinite series of “interpretants” or subjective impressions made by the sign upon human knowers. Thus, Peirce correlates meaning with an ongoing and indeterminate historical process interpretation. Finally, Peirce was a staunch anti-determinist and advocated tychism, the belief that the operations of the natural world were not fixed and regular, but exhibit considerable spontaneity.

James is considered a process philosopher for several reasons. He stresses that true empiricism requires that we acknowledge the continuous flow of experience (the “blooming buzzing confusion”) as our primary datum rather than individual and discrete physical objects. Also, James was a strong proponent of libertarianism (the belief in genuinely free choice, not the political ideology) and argued that determinism was not a genuine candidate for belief. James also advocated a metaphysics of “pure experience” late in his career, which puts forth the hypothesis that both mind and matter are manifestations of a more primary experiential “stuff.”

Dewey exhibited process themes in his philosophy of education and epistemology. First, Dewey’s philosophy of education criticized the rote memorization of facts, and advocated the development of critical thinking faculties and problem solving abilities, thus shifting the emphasis from the accumulation of static propositions to building capacities for appropriating new insight. Likewise, Dewey’s epistemology of transaction argues that no belief should be considered final, as human knowledge is in a constant state of revision and development. Likewise, the naming of objects is always tentative and human knowing cannot be divorced from its temporal context.

b. The Whitehead-Hartshorne Tradition

Despite these rich and varied contributions, the term “process philosophy” (as well as “process theology” and “process thought”) has become virtually synonymous with the neo-naturalist philosophical legacy left by Alfred North Whitehead (1861-1947) and Charles Hartshorne (1897-2000). This association was popularized among those theologians and philosophers of the mid-century “Chicago School.” For this reason, the remainder of this essay will primarily focus on the Whiteheadian-Hartshornean school of process philosophy. Contemporary philosophers in this school include Lewis Ford, David Ray Griffin, Robert Neville, Victor Lowe, Donald Sherburne, Donald Wayne Viney, Jude Jones, John Lango, Daniel Dombrowski, Randall Auxier, and C. Robert Mesle, among others. Notable characteristics of this variant of process philosophy are its (1) method of metaphysical speculation, (2) event (rather than substance) ontology, (3) assertion of panpsychism or panexperientialism, (4) description of “prehension” in place of perception, and (5) panentheist doctrine of God.

2. Assumptions and Method

a. In Pursuit of a Holistic Worldview

Whitehead begins the preface to his Science and the Modern World (1925) by noting that the human intuitions of science, aesthetics, ethics, and religion each make a positive contribution to the worldview of a community. In each historical period, any one or combination of these intuitions may receive emphasis and thus influence the dominant worldview of its people. It is a peculiar characteristic of the last three (now four) centuries that scientific pursuits have come to dominate the worldview of Western minds. For this reason, Whitehead seeks to establish a comprehensive cosmology—understood here in the sense of a systematic descriptive theory of the world—that does justice to all of the human intuitions and not only the scientific ones. Toward this end, Whitehead argues that philosophy is the “critic of cosmologies,” whose job it is to synthesize, scrutinize and make coherent the divergent intuitions gained through ethical, aesthetic, religious, and scientific experience. Process philosophy is frequently used as a conceptual bridge to facilitate discussions between religion, philosophy, and science.

b. Neo-Classical Realism

Process philosophy represents an aberration in the history of philosophy, as it rejects the peculiarly Modern practice of beginning with philosophical analysis of the knowing subject and moving outwards toward descriptions of the world. Since Rene Descartes, epistemology (the investigation of the origin, structure, methods and validity of knowledge) has been primary and foundational, while ontology (the study of fundamental principles of being) has been secondary and only attempted once its possibility has been established by epistemological analysis.

Process philosophers, however, tend to embrace the reverse, which was more common in classical Greek philosophy. Rather than beginning with subjectivity, process philosophy seeks to describe the world first and the subject’s place in it second. Hartshorne adopted the descriptor “neoclassical” to describe his philosophy and especially his doctrine of God. Hartshorne was neoclassical not only because his philosophy was theocentric rather than egocentric, but also because of his strong tendencies toward rationalism. (Hartshorne defended a variety of the ontological argument for the existence of God.) This neoclassical realist approach circumvents philosophical attacks on metaphysics (for example, Kant’s transcendental critique) that arose in the Modern period. It is a matter of debate between process philosophers and their critics, however, whether process philosophy is pre-modern or post-modern in this respect.

c. Speculative Metaphysics

Process philosophy as a whole employs three methodologies, usually simultaneously: empiricism (knowledge from experience), rationalism (knowledge from deduction), and speculation (knowledge from imagination). Whitehead’s famous metaphor for philosophy from the opening pages of his opus Process and Reality (1929) is that of a short airplane flight. Philosophy begins on the ground with the concrete reality of lived experience. Experience provides us with the raw data for our theories. Then, our thought takes off, losing contact with the ground and soaring into heights of imaginative speculation. During speculation, we use rational criteria and imagination to synthesize facts into a (relatively) systematic worldview. In the end, however, our theories must eventually land and once again make contact with the ground—our speculations and hypotheses must ultimately answer once again to the authority of experience. Though one of Whitehead’s more infamous aphorisms is that “it is more important that an idea be interesting than true,” he insists that speculative theories be both coherent and adequate to the facts of experience. By taking this airplane flight as a model for speculative metaphysics, Whitehead envisions the process of metaphysics to consist in an unending series of “test flights,” as our metaphysical conclusions are never final and always hypothetical. The process of adjusting our metaphysics to meet the demands of experience is a task with no end in sight, as experience continually provides the philosopher with new facts. Thus, process metaphysics regards the status of its own claims as contingent and tentative. This differs significantly from classical metaphysical systems, which are regarded as final, authoritative, and necessary.

3. Basic Metaphysics

a. Creativity as Ultimate

Whitehead argues that the best description of ultimate reality is through the principle of creativity. Creativity is the universal of universals—that which is only actual in virtue of its accidents or instances. Thus, creativity is frequently compared to the notions of Aristotle’s “being qua being,” Martin Heidegger’s “Being itself” (more appropriately “Becoming itself”), or even the material cause of all events. Creativity is the most general notion at the base of all that actually exists. Thus, all actual entities, even God, are in a sense “creatures” of creativity.

Whitehead also characterizes creativity as the principle of novelty. The events of the past are ceaselessly synthesized into a new and unique event, which becomes data for future events. “The many become one, and are increased by one,” (Whitehead, Process and Reality, 20). This focus on oscillation between one and many forms the foundation of the process metaphysic.

b. Events, not Substances

The most counter-intuitive doctrine of process philosophy is its sharp break from the Aristotelian metaphysics of substance, that actuality is not made up of inert substances that are extended in space and time and only externally related to each other. Process thought instead states that actuality is made up of atomic or momentary events. These events, called actual entities or actual occasions, are “the final real things of which the world is made up,” (Whitehead, Process and Reality, 18). They occur very briefly and are characterized by the power of self-determination and subjective immediacy (though not necessarily conscious experience). In many ways, actual occasions are similar to Leibniz’s monads [link], except that occasions are internally related to each other.

The enduring objects one perceives with the senses (for example, rocks, trees, persons, etc.) are made up of serially ordered “societies,” or strings of momentary actual occasions, each flowing into the next and giving the illusion of an object that is continuously extended in time, much like the rapid succession of individual frames in a film that appear as a continuous picture. Contemporary commentators on process thought suggest that individual actual occasions vary in spatio-temporal “size” and can correspond to the phenomena of sub-atomic particles, atoms, molecules, cells, and human persons (that is, souls). Likewise, these individuals may aggregate together to form larger societies (for example, rocks, trees, animal bodies). According to this model, a single electron would be a series of momentary electron-occasions. Likewise, the human subject would be a series of single occasions that coordinates and organizes many of the billions of other actual occasions that make up the subject’s “physical” body.

Where substance metaphysics and modern science have posited that the world is made up of material objects, Whitehead argues that “organism” is a better term for things that exist. Whereas matter is self-sustaining, externally related, valueless, passive, and without an intrinsic principle of motion; organisms are interdependent, internally and externally related, value-laden, active, and intrinsically active.

c. Internal and External Relations

Process philosophy rejects the doctrine of scientific materialism and substance-based metaphysics that entities can only influence each other by means of external relations. In a metaphysic of material substance, solid bodies are only able to influence other solid bodies by making physical contact with them or exerting some force on them. Although these interaction produce change, they do not affect the intrinsic constitution of the bodies acted upon. As a result, the actualities of materialist metaphysics are able to endure interaction without any changes to their constitution.

Process philosophy asserts that actual occasions influence each other by internal and external relations. When one actual occasion is internally related to another, the past occasions participate in and contribute to the intrinsic character of the present. The primary vehicle for internal relatedness is Whitehead’s notion of prehension. Prehension is the experiential activity of an actual occasion by which characteristics of one occasion come to be present in another. Thus, one occasion may prehend certain qualities of an occasion in its past (for example, a shade of red or a certain proposition). By means of prehension, a past occasion comes to be constitutively present in the contemporary occasion and contributes to its intrinsic character. All actualities prehend. This is not a voluntary or a necessarily conscious activity.

One important consequence of this doctrine is the principle of relativity, which states that every actual occasion is internally related to every other actual occasion in its past (that is, the entire past history of the universe), though the efficacy each past occasion exerts upon the present occasion may vary widely. Thus process philosophers describe the world as a vast and tangled web of relationalty and interdependence.

d. Rejection of Nominalism

Whitehead, who famously asserts that the history of philosophy is safely characterized as “a series of footnotes to Plato” (Whitehead, Process and Reality, 39), resurrects the Platonic notion that the qualities of objects exist independently of any perceiver. This position arises from the need for the actual occasions to take on “forms of definiteness” as they assimilate the data of the past into the particularity of the present. Because Whitehead argues that anything that exerts causal efficacy upon the world must be an actual entity (his “ontological principle”), he denies that universals are free-floating, independently real entities like the Platonic Forms. Instead, Whitehead calls the universals “eternal objects” and locates them in the mind of God, who is an actual entity. The divine actuality, according to Whitehead, primordially envisages and orders the eternal objects into an ideal pattern(s). Eternal objects are tiered in complexity. Several simple eternal objects can be ordered into a single complex eternal object, which would be an ordered arrangement of simpler eternal objects. So a particular shade of green is a relatively simple eternal object, while “green life form” is a more complex eternal object and “vegetable” would be even more complex.

Thus, eternal objects are relevant novel possibilities that are presented to and “ingress” into every actual occasion. The divine actuality mediates eternal objects—both simple and complex—to other actual occasions by means of prehension. These eternal objects make their way into the concrescing (developing) actual occasions when an occasion “feels” them in a past actual occasion or in the divine actuality. A person who experiences a musty smell feels that datum as a complex eternal object that was present in the occasions that make up the moldy book. The direct transmission of eternal objects from the divine actuality to worldly actual occasions is the chief source of novelty in the world.

Though Whitehead and Hartshorne share many metaphysical commitments, Whitehead’s doctrine of eternal objects is one source of significant disagreement between the two process philosophers. Hartshorne argues that although there is a meaningful sense in which specific qualities of phenomena are objectively real, he does not agree that they are “haunting reality from all eternity, as it were, begging for instantiation, nor that God primordially envisages a complete set of such qualities,” (Hartshorne, Creative Synthesis, 59). For example, Hartshorne uses the example that the quality of “being like Shakespeare” could not have existed, even in God’s mind, before Shakespeare’s actual existence.

Hartshorne contends that Whitehead has obscured or overlooked the distinction between what is determinable and what is determinate. The former consists in unactualized possibility that is in no way settled beforehand. Hartshorne asks us to consider the advance possibilities of a painter creating a painting. Certainly the possible outcomes are partially definite. There are only so many pigments in existence and the perceptual range of human vision is fixed, but the precise outcome of this creative act is not pre-existent as an eternal object. Not even God, claims Hartshorne, can anticipate the products of human creativity. Prior to completion, the finished painting is determinable, but not determinate. The process of becoming for Hartshorne is more than the temporally ordered actualization of antecedently (or eternally) present forms—a “vast sum of determinates”—but rather the essentially creative emergence of genuinely novel forms and patterns of infinite range.

Hartshorne, however, does not endorse nominalism, which he defines as the denial of a genuine distinction between the universal and the particular. (Nominalists either deny ontological status to all universals or to all particulars.) In this sense, Hartshorne is a realist, just not as robustly realist as Whitehead. He allows that some universals are eternal (for example, the necessary aspect of deity and numbers), but most are emergent and contingent upon the temporal flow of actual events.

4. The Human Person

a. Panexperientialism with Organizational Duality

Process metaphysics doctrine of panpsychism or panexperientialism state that all individual actual entities—from electrons to human persons—are essentially self-determining and possess the ability to experience the world around them. Although actual entities possess experience, it is not necessarily conscious experience. Whitehead argues that consciousness presupposes experience and not vice versa.

Panexperientialism is another significant departure from the dominant metaphysical theories of idealism (all is mind), dualism (mind and matter are equally fundamental), or materialism (all is matter). Whitehead’s metaphysic is a monistic one. Everything that is actual is composed of actual occasions. Actual occasions are themselves diverse; they vary in size and complexity. Electronic occasions have limited freedom and opportunities, while human persons are capable of incredibly rich experiences. Despite the great range of complexity, these differences are differences of degree, not of kind. Thus, the traditional problems of mind-body interaction are not present in process metaphysics because reality, at its base, is not purely mental or physical. Actual entities, as events, are at their foundation experiential and one can have physical experiences and mental experiences.

Although the system is a monistic one, which is characterized by experience going “all the way down” to the simplest and most basic actualities, there is a duality between the types of organizational patterns to which societies of actual occasions might conform. In some instances, actual occasions will come together and give rise to a “regnant” or dominant society of occasions. The most obvious example of this is when the molecule-occasions and cell-occasions in a body produce, by means of a central nervous system, a mind or soul. This mind or soul prehends all the feeling and experience of the billions of other bodily occasions and coordinates and integrates them into higher and more complex forms of experience. The entire society that supports and includes a dominant member is, to use Hartshorne’s term, a compound individual.

Other times, however, a bodily society of occasions lacks a dominant member to organize and integrate the experiences of others. Rocks, trees, and other non-sentient objects are examples of these aggregate or corpuscular societies. In this case, the diverse experiences of the multitude of actual occasions conflict, compete, and are for the most part lost and cancel each other out. Whereas the society of occasions that comprises a compound individual is a monarchy, Whitehead describes corpuscular societies as “democracies.” This duality accounts for how, at the macroscopic phenomenal level, we experience a duality between the mental and physical despite the fundamentally and uniformly experiential nature of reality. Those things that seem to be purely physical are corpuscular societies of occasions, while those objects that seem to possess consciousness, intelligence, or subjectivity are compound individuals.

b. Perception and Prehension

Every actual occasion receives data from every other actual occasion in its past by means of prehension. Whitehead calls the process of integrating this data by proceeding from indeterminacy to determinacy “concrescence.” Concrescence typically consists of an occasion feeling the entirety of its past actual world, filtering and selecting some data for relevance, and integrating, combining, and contrasting that original data with novel data (provided by the divine occasion) in increasingly complex stages of “feeling” until the occasion reaches “satisfaction” and has become fully actual. Because this process of synthesis involves distilling the entire past universe down into a single moment of particular experience, Whitehead calls a completed actual occasion “superject” or “subject-superject.” After an occasion reaches satisfaction, it becomes an objectively immortal datum for all future occasions.

In human beings (and all other sufficiently complex animals), the concrescing structure of the dominant occasions entails that consciousness is a derivative form of experience that only appears in the latest stage of concrescence. “Consciousness flickers; and even at its brightest, there is a small focal region of clear illumination, and a large penumbral region of experience which tells of intense experience in dim apprehension. The simplicity of clear consciousness is no measure of the complexity of complete experience,” (Whitehead, Process and Reality, 267). Thus, sense perception, because it is conscious, is considered by Whitehead to be a relatively superficial mode of perception. In fact, Whitehead argues that human beings perceive in three modes, of which sensory perception is only one.

Perception in the mode of causal efficacy is Whitehead’s term for the initial prehension by an actual occasion of its entire past world. Whitehead describes the data of the past world coming to bear upon the occasion as “brute fact.” Thus, the occasions of the past exert efficient causation upon the concrescing occasion. Whitehead argues that all actualities experience perception in the mode of causal efficacy, and it is by far the most significant and fundamental mode of causation. Thus, contrary to Hume, we do perceive the causal influence of other actualities, although not always consciously.

Perception in the mode of presentational immediacy is the manifestation of causal efficacy as it “bubbles up” into consciousness. Some examples include uninterpreted blotches of color that one sees or the experience of an audible tone, without comparison to those tones that have already been heard. Presentational immediacy provides the subject with information about the durational present, but not the past or future.

These two “pure” modes of perception—causal efficacy and perceptual immediacy—are combined in the third “impure” mode of perception: symbolic reference. Perception in the mode of symbolic reference is the process by which we identify and correlate those phenomena in causal efficacy with the causally efficacious occasions in our past. Symbolic reference is the conscious (or liminally conscious) activity of assigning referential relations between immediate sensory phenomena and past actualities “out there” in the world. Process philosophy diverges from the skepticism about the world-in-itself engendered by Hume and Imannuel Kant. Human beings are able to perceive causal relations and can correlate noumena and phenomena by means of symbolic reference.

5. God and the World

a. Dipolar Panentheism

In his metaphysical works, Whitehead notes that, given the virtually unlimited number of “forms of definiteness” (that is, eternal objects) available, the “creative advance” of the occasions in the universe would not be possible if there were not some “principle of concretion or limitation” placed upon actuality. This principle must determine which forms are available for instantiation in each object and introduce contraries, grades, and oppositions among those values. The metaphysical system requires a reason that actual occasions take on only a very specific selection of the eternal objects that are available. Thus, God is introduced into the system as the principle of limitation, which actual occasions require. In Whitehead’s system, only actual entities can have causal efficacy. Thus, a divine actual entity was posited. Though Whitehead’s philosophy has inspired an entire tradition of process theology, the doctrine of God at this point (especially in Science and the Modern World) is very thin, theologically speaking. Whitehead was initially a reluctant theist. God appears as a metaphysical necessity—the evaluator and purveyor of universals—and little more.

It is important to note that although God’s envisagement of the eternal objects is “eternal” (that is, causally outside of the temporal flow), God’s own being is that of an everlasting actual entity (Whitehead) or an everlasting society of discrete actual occasions (Hartshorne). Process philosophy’s dedication to naturalism prohibits the postulation of any entities that are exempt from metaphysical principles, especially God, who should be the chief exemplification of the world’s metaphysical principles rather than their sole exception. The tension in the process conception of God between an eternal and unchanging evaluation of eternal objects and a temporal entity internally related to every other actuality has led to Whitehead’s “dipolar” doctrine of God. It is useful to think about God’s being by means of two abstractions: God’s primordial nature and God’s consequent nature. The primordial nature envisages and orders the eternal objects into a single unimaginably complex ideal. The consequent nature of God interacts with the world, prehending fully every single actual occasion in the world upon its concrescence and, thus, preserving the past. This consequent nature of God is the aspect of God that is continuously changing as the world changes and feels every experience in the world with subjective immediacy.

Process philosophers also characterize God’s relation to the world as one of mutual transcendence, mutual immanence, and mutual creation. For example, God transcends the world insofar as God is able to fully synthesize and integrate every occasion in the world and compare that world with the primordial envisagement of ideals. The world transcends God insofar as it is not subject to divine fiat and can disregard God’s lures or presentation of novel possibilities. Likewise, God is the creator of the world in the sense that an orchestra conductor or a poet is a creator—organizing and directing elements that frequently surprise or misinterpret. The world creates God in the sense that the data from the world are internally related and constitutive of God’s being.

The doctrine of God established by process philosophy is a significant departure from previous models of the God-World relation. Process philosophy does not endorse classical theism, understood as the doctrine that God is completely transcendent, supernatural, beyond time and space, simple, and unchanging. Nor does process philosophy endorse pure immanence or pantheism, the doctrine that the world and God are identical and that God is nothing more than the sum of entities in the world. Instead, process philosophy endorses panentheism, the belief that all is in God and God is immanent everywhere in the universe, but is more than the universe. A frequently used analogy here is that the universe is God’s body and God is the consciousness that directs and interacts with that body. God is the divine subject of all experience.

b. Freedom and the Problem of Evil

Because every actual entity, including God, is an instance of creativity and is therefore experiential and self-determining, God is incapable of overriding the self-determination of the creaturely occasions. To exist at all is to be composed of creativity and this necessarily implies both an element of self-determination and a particular pattern of causal relation with all other entities. God is not to be treated as an exception to all metaphysical principles, invoked to save their collapse. God is their chief exemplification. (Process and Reality, 343). God prehends and is prehended just as billions of other actualities are prehended. Ultimately, the syntheses of these data (including divine data) are determined by the concrescing entity, whether that entity is an atmospheric molecule or a human being. God’s power over the world is described as persuasive rather than coercive. God cannot override the self-directed integrations of feeling present in the concrescence of any occasion—God cannot force human beings to make any particular decision and cannot supernaturally intervene in natural processes. God’s power is that of presenting novel eternal objects (possibilities) as a “lure” to the creaturely occasions. For this reason, the God of process philosophy is not omnipotent, if one’s definition of omnipotence includes the ability to perform any conceivable action.

This denial of omnipotence (see Charles Hartshorne’s Omnipotence and Other Theological Mistakes) is process philosophy’s solution to the problem of evil. Because the power of self-determination is a quality of Becoming itself, anything that exists must necessarily possess self-determination. God’s benevolence is not at odds with the existence of moral and natural evils in the world because God’s power cannot prevent creaturely occasions from ignoring the divine lures and acting in a less-than-ideal fashion.

6. Non-theistic Variations

Some later process philosophers (for example, Donald Sherburne, Robert C. Mesle) dispute whether God is truly necessary to Whitehead’s system. They argue that a non-theistic or “naturalistic” version of process philosophy is more useful and coherent. This movement, classically expressed by Donald Sherburne’s 1971 article “Whitehead without God,” observes that Whitehead believes that God is metaphysically necessary because God (a) preserves the past; (b) is the ontological ground, or “somewhere” of the eternal objects; and (c) is the source of order, novelty, and limitation in worldly occasions. Sherburne argues that these roles for God are inconsistent with the metaphysical principles of Whitehead’s system and are superfluous. According to Whitehead’s own principles, God cannot be the ground for the givenness of the past. Likewise, the eternal objects need not be located in an everlasting divine actuality—a rather Platonic formulation—but could be inchoate in the flux of worldly actualities themselves—a more Aristotelian view. Finally, Sherburne points out that a principle of limitation can arise from the naturally ordered causal relevance of the past rather than God. A concrescing occasion is most heavily influenced by the preceding occasion in its immediate past and the determinate character of this occasion limits the possibilities of the present.

7. Process Philosophy as Constructive Postmodernism

“Modernity” in itself is a rather diffuse term, which means many things to many people, and especially varies depending on the disciplinary context. The term “postmodern” is even more ambiguous (and abused). Process philosophy’s place in the history of philosophy is somewhat of an enigma, due to its ambivalent relationship with modernity. In some ways, process philosophy seems pre-modern by virtue of its neo-classicism and unapologetic metaphysical speculation. Process philosophy also embraces modernity in its dedication to the importance of natural science and its metaphysical realism. It is also post-modern in its rejection of both substance metaphysics and the notion of an enduring self.

Many process philosophers, following the lead of David Ray Griffin, refer to their own work as “constructive postmodernism” in order to differentiate it from the deconstruction program of Jacques Derrida, Jean-François Lyotard, Michel Foucault, and others. The latter movements seek to dismantle the notions of system, self, God, purpose, meaning, reality, and truth in order to prevent, among other things, oppressive totalities and hegemonic narratives that arose in the Modern period. Constructive postmodernism, on the other hand, seeks emancipation from the negative aspects of modernity through revision rather than elimination. Constructive postmodernism seeks to revise and re-synthesize the insights and positive features of Modernity into a post-anthropocentric, post-individualistic, post-materialist, post-nationalist, post-patriarchal, and post-consumerist worldview. For example, modernity’s worship of scientific achievement, combined with lingering Aristotelian doctrines of substance and efficient causation may have led to a mechanistic materialist worldview. Deconstructive postmodernism would combat this worldview by undermining the efficacy of science, claiming that all observational statements are actually about our own culturally-constituted conceptual scheme, not about an independently real world. Constructive postmodernism seeks instead to leave natural science intact, because empirical observation itself produces evidence against mechanism and materialism when it takes in a sufficiently broad data set (that is, all of human experience, and not just experience of “physical” objects).

8. Conclusion

Many thinkers have found process philosophy to be most useful because of this ambivalent stance. Whitehead’s own method for resolving philosophical difficulties was to see the polar oppositions present in any philosophical debate (idealism vs. materialism; libertarianism vs. determinism) as two exaggerated positions that arise from an inappropriately narrow selection of data and evidence. Solutions to problems, for process philosophy, are always to be found in novel syntheses of the past judgments.

9. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

Bergson, Henri. Creative Evolution (Kessinger Publications, 2003).
Bergson, Henri. The Creative Mind: An Introduction to Metaphysics (Citadel Press, 1992).
Browning, Douglas and William T. Myers, eds. Philosophers of Process (New York: Fordham, 1998).
- This anthology collects important essays from the broader tradition of process philosophy—C.S. Peirce, William James, Friedrich Nietzsche, Samuel Alexander, Henri Bergson, John Dewey, A.N. Whitehead, George Herbert Mead, and Charles Hartshorne.
Hartshorne, Charles. Creative Synthesis and Philosophic Method (Chicago: Open Court, 1970).
- Hartshorne tackles classical issues in philosophy: proofs for theism, metaphysics and language, a priori knowledge, aesthetic value, and the nature of reality.
Hartshorne, Charles. Insights and Oversights of Great Thinkers (Albany: SUNY Press, 1983).
- Hartshorne presents his own systematic philosophical views by commenting on the major figures in the history of philosophy from the Pre-Socratics to Merleau-Ponty and Sartre.
Hartshorne, Charles. Creativity in American Philosophy (Albany: SUNY Press, 1984).
- Hartshorne comments on the major figures in American philosophy, focusing on their metaphysical commitments, and treatment of “creativity.”
Hartshorne, Charles. Omnipotence and Other Theological Mistakes (Albany: SUNY Press, 1984).
- This short, simple, and lucid work summarizes Hartshorne’s doctrine of God and related philosophical theology.
Hartshorne, Charles. The Zero Fallacy (Chicago: Open Court, 1997).
- This anthology presents diverse essays by Hartshorne on classical theism, democracy, the logic of contrasts, the nature of metaphysics, the mind-body problem, and even ornithology.
Whitehead, Alfred North. Science and the Modern World (New York: The Free Press, 1925).
- By arguing that the rise of modern science is a contingent and idiosyncratic cultural fluke, rather than an inevitable intellectual achievement, Whitehead establishes the framework for his own holistic metaphysical system.
Whitehead, Alfred North. Religion in the Making (New York: Fordham, 1926).
- By examining the history, phenomenology, and sociology of religion, Whitehead discusses the important interrelation of religious experience, scientific experience, and metaphysical philosophy.
Whitehead, Alfred North. Process and Reality (New York: The Free Press, 1929).
- In his highly technical and dense opus, Whitehead systematically describes his unique “philosophy of organism.”
Whitehead, Alfred North. Adventures of Ideas (New York: The Free Press, 1933).
- By examining the history of civilization, Whitehead explores the notions of widescale moral progress of civilization, the infusion of values and ideals in the world, the God-world relation, and the importance of novelty and adventure for human inquiry.

b. Secondary Sources

Cobb, John B., Jr. and Griffin, David Ray. Process Theology: An Introductory Exposition (Philadelphia: Westminster Press, 1976).
- This book applies the metaphysics of Whitehead and Hartshorne to explicitly theological problems.
Cobb, John B., Jr. and Griffin, David Ray. Postmodernism and Public Policy: Reframing Religion, Culture, Education, Sexuality, Class, Race, Politics, and the Economy (Albany: SUNY Press, 2001).
- John B. Cobb, Jr. uses a Whiteheadian perspective to address matters of public policy and social justice.
Cloots, Andre, and Robinson, Keith A.. Deleuze, Whitehead, and the Transformation of Metaphysics (Brussels: Flämische Akademie der Wissenschaften, 2005).
- This work places Whitehead in conversation with French poststructuralist Gilles Deleuze.
Dombrowski, Daniel. A Platonic Philosophy of Religion (Albany: SUNY Press, 2006).
- This work’s interpretive framework derives from the application of process philosophy and discusses the continuation of Plato’s thought in the works of Hartshorne and Whitehead.
Griffin, David Ray. God, Power, and Evil: A Process Theodicy (Philadelphia, Westminster, 1976).
- This work compares traditional theodicies with the Whiteheadian-Hartshornean solution to the problem of evil.
Griffin, David Ray. Reenchantment without Supernaturalism: A Process Philosophy of Religion (Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 2001).
- This book uses process philosophy as an explanatory scheme for major issues in the philosophy of religion—religious language, religious experience and perception, freedom, evil, and morality.
Griffin, David Ray et al. Founders of Constructive Postmodern Philosophy: Peirce, James, Bergson, Whitehead, and Hartshorne. (Albany: SUNY Press, 1993).
- This volume discusses process philosophy as a distinctively postmodern trajectory of thought.
Jones, Judith. Intensity: An Essay in Whiteheadian Ontology (Nashville: Vanderbilt University Press, 1998).
Keller, Catherine and Anne Daniell, eds. Process and Difference: Between Cosmological and Poststructuralist Postmodernisms (Albany: SUNY Press, 2002).
- This collection of essays engages the process philosophical tradition with the poststructuralist movements.
LeClerc, Ivor. Whitehead’s Metaphysics (New Jersey: Humanities Press, 1958).

Author Information

J. R. Hustwit
Email: jhustwit@methodist.edu
Methodist University
U. S. A.

Panpsychism

Panpsychism is the view that all things have a mind or a mind-like quality. The word itself was coined by the Italian philosopher Francesco Patrizi in the sixteenth century, and derives from the two Greek words pan (all) and psyche (soul or mind). This definition is quite general, and raises two immediate questions: (1) What does one mean by “all things”? (2) What does one mean by “mind”? On the first question, some philosophers have argued that literally every object in the universe, every part of every object, and every system of objects possesses some mind-like quality. Other philosophers have been more restrictive, arguing that only certain broad classes of things possess mind (in which case one is perhaps not a true panpsychist), or that, at least, the smallest parts of things—such as atoms—possess mind. The second question—what is mind?—is more difficult and contentious. Here panpsychism is on neither better nor worse footing than any other approach to mind; it argues only that one’s notion of mind, however conceived, must apply in some degree to all things.

The panpsychist conception of mind must be sufficiently broad to plausibly encompass humans and non-human objects as well. Panpsychists typically see the human mind as a unique, highly-refined instance of some more universal concept. They argue that mind in, say, lower animals, plants, or rocks is neither as sophisticated nor as complex as that of human beings. But this in turn raises new questions: What common mental quality or qualities are shared by these things? And why should we even call such qualities “mental” in the first place?

Panpsychism, then, is not a formal theory of mind. Rather, it is a conjecture about how widespread the phenomenon of mind is in the universe. Panpsychism does not necessarily attempt to define “mind” (although many panpsychists do this), nor does it necessarily explain how mind relates to the objects that possess it. As a result, panpsychism is more of an overarching concept, a kind of meta-theory of mind. More details are required to incorporate it into a fully-developed theory of mind.

A view such as panpsychism seems perhaps unlikely at first glance. And in fact many contemporary philosophers have argued that panpsychism is simply too fantastic or improbable to be true. However, there is actually a very long and distinguished history of panpsychist thinking in Western philosophy, from its beginnings in ancient Greece through the present day. Some of the greatest names in philosophy have argued for some form of panpsychism, or expressed a strong sympathy toward the idea. Notably, as we progress into the 21st century, we find the beginnings of a philosophical renaissance for the subject. Once again panpsychism is finding a place in the larger philosophical discourse, and is being explored in a number of different ways.

The Concept of Panpsychism
A Historical Overview
Arguments: Pro and Con
Panpsychism vs. Emergentism
References and Further Reading

1. The Concept of Panpsychism

In a general sense, panpsychism may be defined as the view that all things possess mind, or some mind-like quality. The specific meanings of “all things” and “mind” vary widely among particular thinkers, but there is a broad consensus on three points. First, the mind in all things is something internal to, or inherent in, things themselves (as opposed to being injected or sustained by some outside entity). Second, such mind has a sort of focus or unity to it, in that it is typically assumed to be of a singular nature. Third, “things” usually (but not always) include systems or collections of lower-order entities; thus, a forest may be considered as a thing, though it is composed of a variety of individual trees, plants, animals, and so forth.

Panpsychist theories generally attempt to encompass both the material realm and the mental realm in a single comprehensive framework, in a way that fundamentally connects the two. These realms are central to many aspects of philosophy, but panpsychism lies at a unique intersection of the two, wherein mind is seen as fundamental to the nature of existence and being. It is at once an ontology and a theory of mind.

This latter point requires elaboration. Panpsychism, in itself, is not a theory of mind per se, because it does not in general give an account of the precise nature of mind, nor of how it relates to material things. Rather, it is a meta-theory; it is a theory about theories, a framework which says: However mind is to be conceived, it applies, in some sense, to all things.

Thus panpsychism can apply, in principle, to virtually any conventional theory of mind. There could exist, for example, a panpsychist substance dualism in which some Supreme Being grants a soul/mind to all things. There could be a panpsychist functionalism that interprets the functional role of every object as mind, even if such a role is only “to gravitate,” “to resist pressure,” and so forth. One could argue for a panpsychist identism in which mind is identical to matter; or a panpsychist reductive materialism in which the mind of each thing is reducible to its physical states. The only theories not amenable to panpsychism are those that (a) explicitly argue that only a certain restricted class of beings can possess mind (such as living things or Homo sapiens), or (b) deny the existence of mind altogether (that is, eliminativism). The fact that such restricted conceptions of mind are on shaky theoretical ground suggests that one should not rule out the panpsychist extension of other theories. Rather, the opposite view is perhaps the more reasonable: that one should hold panpsychism as a natural and logical extension of any given theory of mind, until demonstrated otherwise.

A few further points should be made clear at the outset of any discussion of panpsychism. First, philosophers typically do not take panpsychism in the literal sense, meaning all things have a soul; this interpretation of psyche is primarily a remnant of the theological philosophy of the Renaissance. Psyche is today most often interpreted as synonymous with mind or, in a secular sense, spirit.

Second, panpsychism needs to be distinguished from some closely related concepts: animism, hylozoism, pantheism, panentheism, and panexperientialism:

Animism, as commonly understood, is the view that all things possess a fully-developed, intelligent, and complex conscious-like spirit. It is a concept arising more from mythology than philosophy, and few panpsychists actually attribute human-like (or god-like) consciousness to all objects.
Hylozoism is the theory that everything is alive. This concept originated in ancient philosophy when the notion of life was less well-understood, and hence easily conflated with ideas of spirit and mind. Thus when past writers argue that “everything is alive” we are justified in interpreting this in a panpsychist light. The term has been used sporadically even through the early twentieth century, but based on our current understanding of living organisms, it is less useful or appropriate today.
Pantheism identifies everything, collectively, with God, as a single unified being. For the pantheist, the universe itself is God. In general this says nothing about individual things, nor about the nature of mind, and hence has no direct bearing on panpsychism (though some panpsychists do equate God with the cosmos, and hence are pantheists as well—Spinoza being the prime example).
Panentheism is the view that God penetrates, or is in, everything. Again, this typically assumes a single unified God, whose omnipresence is taken as the spirit in all things. Such a view is actually close to the standard Christian position, where the Holy Spirit dwells everywhere. But because it offers a notion of spirit as a part of a unified God, and not as spirit of the thing itself, it is not a true form of panpsychism.
Finally, panexperientialism is a term that was invented by process philosopher David Ray Griffin in the 1970’s. It holds that everything experiences, or is capable of experiencing.

Of the above terms, only panexperientialism deserves to be considered as true panpsychism; the others are either archaic or largely irrelevant. And due to the prominence of process philosophy over the past few decades, panexperientialism is perhaps the most widely discussed form of panpsychism today.

The process view of panpsychism raises a third issue. When process philosophers argue that all things have a mind or that all things experience, they refer to all “true” or “genuine” individuals. A human being is a genuine individual, as are all animals. One-celled microbes are included, as well as cells in the animal body. Plant cells count as individuals, but, interestingly, whole plants do not—based on a particular reading of some rather cryptic statements by Whitehead. On the process view, rocks and tables are not individuals, but the atoms and molecules that compose them are. Since atoms are seen as possessing mind, all material things are thereby enminded: either as individuals in themselves, or as a collection of sentient atoms. It should be emphasized, however, that the process view is a minority position; most panpsychists throughout history have held to the stronger view that all things possess mind.

Finally, it is clearly debatable what one means by “mind.” Panpsychists have employed a variety of descriptive terms to articulate the mental quality that all things share: sentience, experience, feeling, inner life, subjectivity, qualia, will, perception. In the vast majority of cases such terms are used in a very broad sense, and are not defined in a specifically human sense. In fact, panpsychists deliberately avoid terms that are too closely identified with uniquely human mental characteristics, such as consciousness (or self-consciousness), cognition, thought, belief, and the like. The usual intention is that only mind in the broadest sense is applicable to all things.

2. A Historical Overview

a. Ancient Philosophy

Panpsychism is an ancient concept in Western philosophy, predating even the earliest writings of the pre-Socratics. It was in fact an essential part of the cosmology into which philosophy was born. Thus we should not be too surprised to find its influence recurring throughout our history.

We see evidence of this at the very beginning of philosophy, in the few remaining fragments of Thales, the man widely regarded as the first philosopher of ancient Greece. Thales believed that the lodestone (magnet) possessed a psyche or soul: “According to Thales…the lodestone has a soul because it moves iron” (Aristotle, De Anima, 405a19). Furthermore, the power of the lodestone was seen as a particularly powerful manifestation of a divine animate quality shared by all things: “Certain thinkers say that soul is intermingled in the whole universe, and it is perhaps for that reason that Thales came to the opinion that all things are full of gods” (Ibid, 411a7).

Other pre-Socratics held similar views:

Anaximenes put forth the pneuma (air) as the underlying arche, or ruling principle, of the cosmos. Pneuma has a number of related meanings, many of which correspond closely with psyche; in addition to “air” it can also mean breath, soul, spirit, or mind. Since pneuma penetrates and underlies all things, this implies that all things are endowed with a spiritual or soul-like quality.
Heraclitus’ arche was fire. Fire, like the pneuma, was associated with life-energy; thus Heraclitus referred to this fire not merely as pyr, but as pyr aeizoon – an “ever-living fire.” Consequently, this life-energy was seen as residing in all things: “All things are full of souls and of divine spirits” (Smith, 1934: 13). In another fragment he proclaimed: “The thinking faculty is common to all” (Freeman, 1948: 32).
Anaxagoras envisioned the world as composed of a myriad of substances, but these were ordered and regulated by the single over-arching principle of nous (mind). Nous was a unifying, cosmic mental force that was interwoven with the movement and actions of disparate elements. The mind that is ubiquitous is not just some amorphous, abstract mind, but essentially like that of animals, that is, an animated soul or spirit: “[J]ust as in animals, so in nature, mind is present and responsible for the world…” (Aristotle, Metaphysics, 984b15).

Of special note is the thinking of Empedocles. He invented the four-element view of the cosmos—fire, air, water, and earth—that held for nearly two millennia. All things, including psyche, were composed of these four substances. Furthermore, the elements themselves were seen as ensouled: “Empedocles [says that the soul] is composed of all the elements and that each of them actually is a soul” (Aristotle, De Anima, 404b11). These elements were presided over by two animate forces, Love (attraction) and Strife (repulsion). Hence panpsychism was central to Empedocles’ worldview. Guthrie (1962-81: 233) stated that “it was in fact fundamental to Empedocles’ whole system that there is no distinction between animate and inanimate, and everything has some degree of awareness and power of discrimination.” Perhaps the clearest indication comes in fragment 103: “all things have the power of thought” (Smith, 1934: 31).

Moving to the heart of Greek philosophy, Plato made a number of intriguing comments in support of panpsychism. Notably, passages suggesting such a view occur in four of his last works – Sophist,Philebus, Timaeus, and Laws. This implies that they represent his mature thinking on the matter, and thus have some strong degree of significance in his overall metaphysical system.

Sophist discusses Plato’s ideas about the Form of Being. Since being, on Plato’s view, has the power of self-generating motion (247e), he concludes that the Form of Being must itself have an inherent psychic aspect:

O heavens, can we ever be made to believe that motion [kinesi] and life [zoe] and soul [psyche] and mind [phronesi] are not present with perfect being? Can we imagine that, being is devoid of life and mind, and exists in awful unmeaningness an everlasting fixture? — That would be a dreadful thing to admit (249a).

All real things participate in the Form of Being, as this is how they acquire their actual existence. Thus, everything may be said to participate in life, mind, and soul.

In the Philebus Plato introduced the concept of the anima mundi—the world-soul (30a). He argued that the universe, like the human body, is composed of the four Empedoclean elements (fire, air, water, earth). Both the human and the cosmos are well-ordered and exhibit clear signs of logos, of rationality. The body, though nothing more than a well-ordered combination of the elements, possesses a soul; therefore a reasonable implication is that the universe too, and everything in it, are ensouled. If this were not the case, then there must be something fundamentally unique about the structure of mankind and the cosmos that they alone are ensouled. Plato gave no indication that this is true and, in fact, argued later to the contrary.

Timaeus contains an account of how the creator of the universe—the Demiurge—brought the cosmos into existence, and endowed it with a world-soul. One learns that not only is the cosmos as a whole ensouled, but so too are the stars, individually; they are “divine living things” (40b), for which “[the Demiurge] assigned each soul to a star” (41e). As well the Earth, described as a “god” (40c), “foremost” in the cosmos. Later (77b) Plato explains that even plants possess the third kind of soul (appetitive), and thus are animate.

Finally, in Laws Plato offers perhaps his final statement on the matter:

Now consider all the stars and the moon and the years and the months and all the seasons: what can we do except repeat the same story? A soul or souls…have been shown to be the cause of all these phenomena, and whether it is by their living presence in matter…or by some other means, we shall insist that these souls are gods. Can anybody admit all this and still put up with people who deny that ‘everything is full of gods’? (899b).

In a nod to the famous line by Thales, Plato seems to resolve this issue for us: everything is full of gods.

Regarding Aristotle, we know that he viewed the psyche or soul as the form (or structure) of living things. Accordingly, non-living things have no soul—hence, technically, Aristotle was no panpsychist. But the question remains whether non-living things have something soul-like in them.

First, we note that there is a kind of evolutionary imperative in Aristotle’s thinking. He envisioned all of nature as continually striving toward “the better” or “the good” (see Physics 192a18; On Generation and Corruption 336b28; Eudemian Ethics 1218a30). By “better” Aristotle has in mind certain specific qualities; he comments that being is better than non-being, life better than non-life, and soul better than matter. Thus, as Rist (1989: 123) points out, there is a meaningful sense in which “the whole of the cosmos is permeated by some kind of upward desire and aspiration”—upward in the sense of toward form, life, and soul.

This outlook is essential to Aristotle because he sought to explain the puzzling phenomenon of spontaneous generation. Plant and animal life seem to materialize out of inanimate matter—such as the maggots and flies that quickly appear in decaying animal waste. How is this possible? The upward striving of matter is part of the explanation, but not the whole story.

Aristotle argued that all natural (as opposed to manmade) objects possess an inherent “principle of motion” (Physics 192b9). This fact permits one to see such motion as “an immortal never-failing property of things that are, a sort of life as it were to all naturally constituted things” (Physics, 250b12). The “sort of life” in matter was no idle concept, but directly connected to the process of spontaneous generation. This life-energy initiates the generative process, thus bringing into being true life and soul.

The life-energy in all things had to be grounded in some kind of substance, in order to be manifest in the real world. So Aristotle adopted, perhaps via Anaximenes, the notion of the pneuma. The pneuma is not, strictly speaking, mind or soul; rather, it is something soul-like. As he says in Generation of Animals, it is the “faculty of all kinds of soul,” the “vital heat” (thermoteta psychiken), the “principle of soul” (736b29).

The soul-like pneuma is ubiquitous in the natural world, penetrating and informing all things. It not only brings soul to the embryo and to the spontaneously-generated creatures, but it accounts for the general desire of matter for form, and for the good. Aristotle is explicit and unambiguous that all things are inspirited by the pneuma. With rather stunning clarity he informs us:

Animals and plants come into being in earth and in liquid because there is water in earth, and pneuma in water, and in all pneuma is vital heat, so that in a sense all things are full of soul (Generation of Animals 762a18-20).

Echoing panpsychist thinking from Thales to Plato, Aristotle apparently came to the conclusion that something soul-like, of varying degrees, inhered in all objects of the natural world.

Post-Aristotelian (Hellenistic) Greek philosophy continued to incorporate panpsychist themes. The two dominant schools of that era were those of Epicurus and the Stoics.

Epicurean physical theory relied heavily on the atomism of Democritus, and followed his central thesis of material objects as composed of atoms moving through the void. The early atomists held to a strict determinism, but this was problematic for Epicurus, as his ethical system required the existence of free will. He therefore discarded the determinism by introducing a new factor that he called “swerve” (parenklisis; in Latin, declinare, a deflection or turning-aside). The swerve was due to a tiny amount of free will exhibited by all atoms.

The willful swerving of the atoms is the basis for our own free will. As Lucretius describes it, “[Out of the swerve] rises, I say, that will torn free from fate, through which we follow wherever pleasure leads, and likewise swerve aside at times and places” (pp. 255-60). Human free will cannot arise ex nihilo (“since nothing, we see, could be produced from nothing”; p. 287), and hence must be present in the atoms themselves: “Thus to the atoms we must allow…one more cause of movement [namely, that of free will]—the one whence comes this power we own” (pp. 284-6). The necessary conclusion, then, is that since all things are composed of willful atoms, all things can be said to be animate.

The early Stoic philosophers— Zeno, Cleanthes, and Chrysippus—adopted many of their predecessors’ fundamental assumptions about the nature of being and mind, most importantly the Aristotelian/Anaximean conception of the pneuma. Composed of fire and air, the Stoic pneuma was put forth as the creative life energy of the universe. This was most evident in human bodies, in which both warmth (fire) and breath (air) were seen as the essential defining characteristics of life and soul. Pneuma was the active principle made tangible, and as such it accounted for all form that was seen in worldly objects. Pneuma was the “creative fire” of the cosmos, a pyr technikon. It had the status of divinity, and was equated with both god and cosmic reason.

A. A. Long (1974) notes that in the Stoic system “mind and matter are two constituents or attributes of one thing, body, and this analysis applies to human beings as it does to everything else” (p. 171). All material objects are “bodies,” and they are in fact “compounds of ‘matter’ and ‘mind’ (God or logos). Mind is not something other than body but a necessary constituent of it, the ‘reason’ in matter” (p. 174).

b. Renaissance Thinking

The end of Hellenism and the Stoic philosophy coincided with the beginnings of the monotheistic religious worldview. Monotheism and the Christian worldview were fundamentally opposed to panpsychism, and thus it is perhaps not surprising that we find relatively little articulation of panpsychist ideas for several centuries.

The next major advance did not occur until the Italian Renaissance. Five of the most important philosophers of that era—Cardano, Telesio, Patrizi, Bruno, and Campanella—were panpsychists.

Cardano was the first notable philosopher in over a millennium to put forth an unambiguous panpsychist philosophy. His ontological system consisted of a nested hierarchy in which each individual thing was seen as (1) a part (of the larger whole, or One), (2) a unity in itself, and (3) a composition of sub-parts. The fundamental principle maintaining the unity of each part was anima (soul); the particularly human form of this principle he recognized as mind. As the unifying principle, soul was present in all unities large and small.

Like Empedocles, Telesio saw two fundamental and opposing forces in the universe: an expanding and motive principle that he called heat, and a contracting principle, cold. These forces acted on and shaped the so-called third principle, passive matter, which was associated with the Earth. Every object was a composition of passive matter and the heat/cold principles. Heat and cold also had the notable property of perception. Heat sought to stay warm, and cold to stay cool, and this tendency Telesio interpreted as a kind of sensation or knowledge. As he says, “It is quite evident that nature is propelled by self-interest” (1586/1967: 304). And since heat and cold inhered in all things, all things shared in this ability to sense. Thus his position is sometimes referred to as pansensism, a particular form of panpsychism.

Patrizi’s chief work, New Philosophy of the Universe (1591), laid out a complete cosmological system, and introduced into the Western vocabulary the term “panpsychism.” Following the model of Ficino, Patrizi created a nine-level hierarchical system of being, with soul (anima) in the center. As such it permeated all levels, existing simultaneously at the level of the world-soul, the human soul, and the soul of inanimate things. “Patrizi does not treat the individual souls as [mere] parts of the world soul, but believes, rather, that their relation to their bodies is analogous to that of the world soul to the universe as a whole” (Kristeller, 1964: 122). Soul is “both [unity and plurality], with the many contained in the one” (Brickman, 1941: 41).

Bruno was very frank about his panpsychist view, and even acknowledged its unconventionality. In his 1584 dialogue, Cause, Principle and Unity, one character exclaims, “Common sense tells us that not everything is alive. … [W]ho will agree with you?” Another replies, “But who could reasonably refute it?” (1998: 42). Bruno believed that the same principles must apply throughout the cosmos; the Earth held no privileged position in the universe (such as being at the center), and humans held no privilege with respect to possessing a soul. He took the world-soul and the human soul as given, and concluded that all things, all parts of the whole, must be animated: “[N]ot only the form of the universe, but also all the forms of natural things are souls.” He adds, “there is nothing that does not possess a soul and that has no vital principle” (p. 43). The skeptic retorts: “Then a dead body has a soul? So, my clogs, my slippers, my boots…are supposedly animated?” Bruno clarifies his position by explaining that such “dead” things are not to be considered animate in themselves, but rather as containing elements that either are themselves animate or have the innate power of animation:

I say, then, that the table is not animated as a table, nor are the clothes as clothes…but that, as natural things and composites, they have within them matter and form [that is, soul]. All things, no matter how small and miniscule, have in them part of that spiritual substance… [F]or in all things there is spirit, and there is not the least corpuscle that does not contain within itself some portion that may animate it (p. 44).

Campanella’s system centered on his doctrine of the “three primalities”: power, wisdom, and love. These are three qualities that Campanella saw as residing in all things, from the lowliest rock to the human being, to God himself. He argued that all things possess wisdom and sensation, and therefore can be said to possess the power of knowing. First and foremost, things know themselves: “All things have the sensation of their own being and of their conservation. They exist, are conserved, operate, and act because they know” (in Bonansea, 1969: 156). Cassirer (1963: 148) noted “Panpsychism emerges as a simple corollary to his theory of knowledge.” We see this, very explicitly, in the subtitle of Campanella’s workDe sensu rerum:

A remarkable tract of occult philosophy in which the world is shown to be a living and truly conscious image of God, and all its parts and particles thereof to be endowed with sense perception, some more clearly, some more obscurely, to the extent required for the preservation of themselves and of the whole in which they share sensation.

Campanella offered a number of arguments in support of his panpsychism. For example, following Epicurus and Telesio he argued that “like comes from like,” that is, that emergence is impossible:

Now, if the animals are sentient…and sense does not come from nothing, the elements whereby they and everything else are brought into being must be said to be sentient, because what the result has the cause must have. Therefore the heavens are sentient, and so [too] the earth… (cited in Dooley, 1995: 39).

Campanella was an important thinker, but the two great panpsychists of the seventeenth century were certainly Spinoza and Leibniz. Spinoza created a radical monism in which the single underlying substance of all reality was what he identified as “God, or Nature.” God/Nature possessed two knowable attributes: mind (thought) and matter (extension).

In Spinoza’s psycho-physical parallelism, every object has both its own unique mode of extension and its corresponding mode of thought (also called the “idea” of the object): “In God [/Nature] there is necessarily the idea…of all things…” (Ethics, II Prop 3). Moreover, the idea of an object has a very specific interpretation: it is the mind of that object. Since every object has a corresponding idea, every object can be said to have a mind. This is most apparent to us in our own case, wherein the human mind is simply the idea of the human body. But it is a general ontological principle, and thus applies to all things:

From these [propositions] we understand not only that the human mind is united to the body, but also what should be understood by the union of mind and body. […] For the things we have shown so far are completely general and do not pertain more to man than to other individuals, all of which, though in different degrees, are nevertheless animate. … [W]hatever we have asserted of the idea [that is, mind] of the human body must necessarily also be asserted of the idea of everything else (ibid: II Prop. 13, Scholium).

There is some considerable disagreement as to the proper interpretation of Spinoza’s psycho-physical parallelism, and the meaning of the crucial Proposition 13 (above). Yet there seems to be a consensus in recent years that any proper reading will entail some form of panpsychism.

Leibniz’s panpsychism was based on his Monadology, or science of monads. Monads are the point-like constituents of reality, and they possess a number of characteristics that are related to mental qualities. The structure of the monad is to be understood as consisting of two primary qualities, “perception” and “appetite.” Perceptions are the changing internal states of the monads, and these changes are brought about (in a rather vague way) by the monad’s appetite; the appetite was a kind of seeking or desiring, a compelling need to reflect the universe.

The strongly animistic tone of the terms perception and appetite is not coincidental; each monad is identified with a soul:

I found that [the monad’s] nature consists in force, and that from this there follows something analogous to sensation [that is, perception] and appetite, so that we must conceive of them on the model of the notion we have of souls (1989: 139).

Monads themselves are unities, but so too, in a different way, are collections of monads. Any material object is such a collection, and is integrated by the action of a “dominant monad” which represents the integrated unity of the object. Leibniz, following Bruno, made a critical distinction between objects with a truly organic sense of unity and objects that are mere sets, collections, or aggregations of distinct things. Aggregates such as “an army or a flock,” or “a heap of stones” do not possess a dominant monad and thus no unified mind. Interestingly, Leibniz never gave a formal definition as to what qualifies as a group and what defines a true individual. Nonetheless, all things—even mere aggregates—possess mind, if only in their parts. Of this Leibniz was clear: “[W]e see that there is a world of creatures, of living beings, of animals, of entelechies, of souls in the least part of matter” (Monadology, sec. 66).

c. Eighteenth and Nineteenth Centuries

French thinkers Julien LaMettrie and Denis Diderot discarded the concept of the supernatural soul, and concluded that mind, or a mind-like nature, must be present in all matter. This was the view that came to be known as vitalistic materialism. Diderot’s work D’Alembert’s Dream (1769) put forth a very explicit panpsychist view: “this faculty of sensation…is a general and essential quality of matter” (1769/1937: 49). Throughout the dialogue one finds repeated references to the “general sensitivity of matter.” At one point he observes that “[f]rom the elephant to the flea, from the flea to the sensitive living atom, the origin of all, there is no point in nature but suffers and enjoys” (ibid: 80).

In the century following the French Enlightenment, panpsychist thought developed most rapidly in Germany. Among its more prominent advocates: Herder, Schopenhauer, Goethe, Fechner, Lotze, Hartmann, Mach, and Haeckel.

Herder was a dynamist philosopher who argued that Kraft (force or energy) was the single underlying substance of reality. As such it reflected both mental and physical properties. Herder sought to unify the diversity of forces (gravity, electricity, magnetism, and light) under the single framework of Kraft, of which the various Kraefte were different manifestations. The Kraft was at once material-energy, life-energy, spirit, and mind. “[Herder] represents the Kraefte of plants and stones as analogous to the soul. […] [E]ach endowed with a different degree of consciousness…” (Nisbet, 1970: 11). In 1784 he wrote: “All active forces of Nature are, each in its own way, alive; in their interior there must be Something that corresponds to their effects without—as Leibniz himself assumed….”

Schopenhauer’s masterwork, The World as Will and Idea (1819), describes a two-fold system of reality. From one perspective, the world is to be taken according to classical idealism—it exists only as our minds grasp and perceive it, hence as pure idea. On the other hand, the things of the world must also possess an inner reality. When we humans look inside ourselves, we find, ultimately, only forms of wanting, desiring, urging—in short, will. Yet we are material objects, not essentially unlike other material objects; hence all things, not just humans, are, on the inside, will:

We shall accordingly make further use of [the knowledge of the world as will and idea] as a key to the nature of every phenomenon in nature, and shall judge of all objects which are not our own bodies…according to the analogy of our own bodies, and shall therefore assume that as in one aspect they are idea, …so in another aspect, what remains of objects when we set aside their existence as idea of the subject, must in its inner nature be the same as that in us which we call will (1819/1995: 37).

Not just objects, but all the forces of nature are to be seen as forms of will: “[G]enerally every original force manifesting itself in physical and chemical appearances, in fact gravity itself—all these in themselves…are absolutely identical with what we find in ourselves as will” (1836/1993: 20).

Schopenhauer’s theory thus brings an effective unity to the notions of mind and matter:

Now if you suppose the existence of a mind in the human head, […] you are bound to concede a mind to every stone. […] [A]ll ostensible mind can be attributed to matter, but all matter can likewise be attributed to mind; from which it follows that the antithesis [between mind and matter] is a false one (1851/1974: 212-213).

Goethe developed a poetic form of panpsychism that displayed itself chiefly in his writings that personified nature. His most explicit statement came from a short essay of 1828: “Since, however, matter can never exist and act without spirit [Seele], nor spirit without matter, matter is also capable of undergoing intensification, and spirit cannot be denied its attraction and repulsion” (1988: 6). Here we find a beautifully concise articulation of panpsychism: no matter without mind, no mind without matter. This is not to say that mind is identical with matter, nor that one can be reduced to the other. It simply claims (like Spinoza and Schopenhauer) that neither mind nor matter exist without the other.

Fechner’s panpsychism was focused primarily on plant life. The fact that plants have a Seele is of critical importance to him because it serves as the basis for a completely panpsychic universe, and a corresponding new worldview. Fechner’s concept of the plant-soul was based, like Aristotle’s, on a comparison and analogy with other living beings:

[I]s not the plant quite as well organized as the animal, though on a different plan, a plan entirely of its own, perfectly consonant with its idea? If one will not venture to deny that the plant has a life, why deny it a soul? For it is much simpler to think that a different plan of bodily organization built upon the common basis of life indicates only a different plan of psychic organization (1848/1946: 168-9).

The Earth itself is “animated,” and is furthermore “an angel, so rich and fresh and blooming, … turning wholly towards heaven its animated face” (1861/1946: 150, 153). The animate Earth further implies “belief in the animate character of all other stars.”

Lotze’s central work, Microcosmos (1856-64/1885), described a comprehensive philosophical viewpoint based on a rejection of mechanistic thinking. He advocated the notion that all material objects have “a double life, appearing outwardly as matter, and as such manifesting…mechanical [properties, while] internally, on the other hand, moved mentally…” (p. 150). He concluded that “no part of being is any longer devoid of life and animation” (p. 360). Lotze acknowledged the prima facie improbability of his panpsychist view: “Who could endure the thought that in the dust trodden by our feet, in the…cloth that forms our clothing, in the materials shaped into all sorts of utensils…, there is everywhere present the fullness of animated life…?” (p. 361). Ultimately it is the “beauty of the living form [that] is made to us more intelligible by this hypothesis” (p. 366).

Eduard von Hartmann further developed Schopenhauer’s system of the world as will and idea, combining elements of Leibniz, Schelling, and Hegel into a doctrine of spiritual monism. He articulated a worldview in which the unconscious will is the cause of all things. The fact that matter is resolvable into will and idea led Hartmann to accept “the essential likeness of Mind and Matter” (1869/1950, vol. 2: 81): “The identity of mind and matter [becomes] elevated to a scientific cognition, and that, too, not by killing the spirit but by vivifying matter” (ibid: 180).

Mach’s philosophical writings emerged in the early 1880’s. A strong empiricist, he developed a neutral monistic philosophy in which the primary substance of existence was something that he called “sensations.” This realization led him rather suddenly to a panpsychist conception of reality: “Properly speaking the world is not composed of ‘things’…but of colors, tones, pressures, spaces, times, in short what we ordinarily call individual sensations” (1883/1974: 579). Recalling Schopenhauer’s tone, Mach wrote:

We shall then discover that our hunger is not so essentially different from the tendency of sulphuric acid for zinc, and our will not so greatly different from the pressure of a stone, as now appears. We shall again feel ourselves nearer nature, without its being necessary that we should resolve ourselves into a nebulous and mystical mass of molecules, or make nature a haunt of hobgoblins (ibid: 560).

Haeckel developed a monistic philosophy in which both evolution and the unity of all natural phenomena played a major part. The unity and relation of all living things convinced him that all dualities were false, especially the Cartesian dualism of body and mind. Haeckel was explicitly panpsychist by 1892: “One highly important principle of my monism seems to me to be, that I regard all matter as ensouled, that is to say as endowed with feeling (pleasure and pain) and motion…” (p. 486). He offered one argument for panpsychism, namely that “all natural bodies possess determinate chemical properties,” the most important being that of “chemical affinity.” This affinity, Haeckel argued, can only be explained “on the supposition that the molecules… mutually feel each other” (p. 483). Three years later he observed, “Our conception of Monism…is clear and unambiguous; …an immaterial living spirit is just as unthinkable as a dead, spiritless material; the two are inseparably combined in every atom” (1895: 58).

By the latter part of the nineteenth century, panpsychist thought began to develop in England and America. The first major British panpsychist of that time was William Kingdon Clifford. He believed in a form of Spinozist parallelism—that some process of mind exists concurrently with all forms of matter. Clifford cited evolutionary continuity in arguing that there is no point in the chain of material organization at which mind can be conceived to suddenly appear. Fellow Briton Herbert Spencer wrote an article in 1884 explaining that modern physics has revealed the “incredible power” of matter. The scientist is forced to conclude that:

every point in space thrills with an infinity of vibrations passing through it in all directions; the conception to which [the enlightened scientist] tends is much less that of a Universe of dead matter than that of a Universe everywhere alive: alive if not in the restricted sense, still in a general sense (1884: 10).

Royce’s 1892 book, Spirit of Modern Philosophy, introduced a form of panpsychism based on absolute idealism: “The theory of the ‘double aspect’, applied to the facts of the inorganic world, suggests at once that they, too, in so far as they are real, must possess their own inner and appreciable aspect” (1892: 419-20). A few years later he added this observation:

[W]e have no sort of right to speak in any way as if the inner experience behind any fact of nature were of a grade lower than ours, or less conscious, or less rational, or more atomic. […] [T]his reality is, like that of our own experience, conscious, organic, full of clear contrasts, rational, definite. We ought not to speak of dead nature (1898/1915: 230).

Charles Peirce’s article, “Man’s Glassy Essence” (1892), begins by noting “[T]here is fair analogical inference that all protoplasm feels. It not only feels but exercises all the functions of mind” (1892/1992: 343). And yet protoplasm is simply complex chemistry, a particular arrangement of molecules. We are therefore compelled “[to] admit that physical events are but degraded or undeveloped forms of psychical events” (ibid: 348). Peirce then laid out his own dual-aspect theory of mind:

[A]ll mind is directly or indirectly connected with all matter, and acts in a more or less regular way; so that all mind more or less partakes of the nature of matter. […] Viewing a thing from the outside, […] it appears as matter. Viewing it from the inside, […] it appears as consciousness (ibid: 349).

d. Twentieth Century to the Present

William James first addressed the subject of panpsychism in his Principles of Psychology. He devoted a full chapter to Clifford’s mind-stuff theory, and displayed notable sympathy to the view. James’ first personal endorsement of panpsychism came in his Harvard lecture notes of 1902-3, in which he noted, “pragmatism would be [my] method and ‘pluralistic panpsychism’ [my] doctrine” (Perry, 1935: 373). In his 1905-6 lecture notes he observed: “Our only intelligible notion of an object in itself is that it should be an object for itself, and this lands us in panpsychism and a belief that our physical perceptions are effects on us of ‘psychical’ realities…” (ibid: 446).

James arrived at a clear and unambiguous position in his 1909 book, A Pluralistic Universe. He explained that his theory of radical empiricism is a form of pluralist monism in which all things are both pure experience and “for themselves,” that is, are objects with their own independent psychical perspectives. In the end he endorsed “a general view of the world almost identical with Fechner’s” (ibid: 309-10). He saw in this new worldview “a great empirical movement towards a pluralistic panpsychic view of the universe” (ibid: 313).

In the early part of the twentieth century, panpsychist philosophy continued to develop rapidly in England and the USA. The dominant philosophical system, the one most connected with panpsychism, was Process Philosophy. Its earliest advocates were Bergson and Whitehead.

Bergson wrote Creative Evolution in 1907. His thesis—that matter is “the lowest degree of mind”—echoes Peirce. He added, following Schopenhauer, that “pure willing [is the] current that runs through matter, communicating life to it” (1907/1911: 206). But Bergson’s clearest elaboration came in Duration and Simultaneity (1922). Here he achieved a true process philosophy wherein all physical events contain a memory of the past. Given his earlier insistence that memory is essential to mind, one can see the conclusion that mind, or consciousness, is in all things:

What we wish to establish is that we cannot speak of a reality that endures without inserting consciousness into it. … [I]t is impossible to imagine or conceive a connecting link between the before and after without an element of memory and, consequently, of consciousness. … We may perhaps feel averse to the use of the word “consciousness” if an anthropomorphic sense is attached to it. [But] there is no need to take one’s own memory and transport it, even attenuated, into the interior of the thing. … It is the opposite course we must follow. … [D]uration is essentially a continuation of what no longer exists into what does exist. This is real time, perceived and lived. … Duration therefore implies consciousness; and we place consciousness at the heart of things for the very reason that we credit them with a time that endures (1922/1965: 48-49).

Whitehead’s panpsychism is relatively well known. It is based in his view of an “occasion of experience” as the ultimate particle of reality, and as possessing both a physical pole and a mental pole. If things are nothing but occasions, and occasions are in part mental, then all things have a mental dimension. In Modes of Thought (1938), in the chapter titled “Nature Alive,” he observed, “this [traditional] sharp division between mentality and nature has no ground in our fundamental observation. […] I conclude that we should conceive mental operations as among the factors which make up the constitution of nature” (p. 156).

Bertrand Russell ultimately came to a neutral monist view in which events were the primary reality, and mind and matter were both constructed from them. After some early, suggestive comments, he became increasingly supportive of panpsychism in the late 1920’s. Russell’s book An Outline of Philosophy(1927) directly addressed this. He wrote: “My own feeling is that there is not a sharp line, but a difference of degree [between mind and matter]; an oyster is less mental than a man, but not wholly un-mental” (p. 209). Part of the reason why we cannot draw a line, he says, is that an essential aspect of mind is memory, and a memory of sorts is displayed even by inanimate objects: “we cannot, on this ground [of memory], erect an absolute barrier between mind and matter. … [I]nanimate matter, to some slight extent, shows analogous behavior” (p. 306). In the summary he adds,

The events that happen in our minds are part of the course of nature, and we do not know that the events which happen elsewhere are of a totally different kind. The physical world…is perhaps less rigidly determined by causal laws than it was thought to be; one might, more or less fancifully, attribute even to the atom a kind of limited free will (p. 311).

Perhaps Russell’s clearest statement came in his Portraits from Memory (1956). Memory is “the most essential characteristic of mind, … using this word [memory] in its broadest sense to include every influence of past experience on present reactions” (pp. 153-4). As before, memory applies to all physical objects and systems:

This [memory] also can be illustrated in a lesser degree by the behavior of inorganic matter. A watercourse which at most times is dry gradually wears a channel down a gully at the times when it flows, and subsequent rains follow [a similar] course… You may say, if you like, that the river bed ‘remembers’ previous occasions when it experienced cooling streams. … You would say [this] was a flight of fancy because you are of the opinion that rivers and river beds do not ‘think’. But if thinking consists of certain modifications of behavior owing to former occurrences, then we shall have to say that the river bed thinks, though its thinking is somewhat rudimentary (p. 155).

In contrast to Whitehead, Charles Hartshorne articulated a clear and explicit form of process panpsychism. Beginning with his Beyond Humanism (1937), he laid out the unambiguous position that all true individuals possess a kind of psyche: “Molecules, atoms, and electrons all show more analogy of behavior to animals than do sticks and stones. The constitutions of inorganic masses may then after all belong on the scale of organic being…” (pp. 111-112). Elaborating on this notion over four decades, through such articles as “Panpsychism” (1950), “Physics and Psychics” (1977), and “The Rights of the Subhuman World” (1979), his panpsychism (or, “psychicalism”) is a clear and consistent theme. He combined the insights of Leibniz with Whitehead’s process view into a system which, he claimed, resolved many long-standing philosophical problems: most notably that it serves as a third way between dualism and materialism. Ultimately, panpsychism/psychicalism is, he says, the most viable ontology available to us—certainly preferable to an utterly unintelligible materialism: “the concept of ‘mere dead insentient matter’ is an appeal to invincible ignorance. At no time will this expression ever constitute knowledge” (1977: 95).

Many other great thinkers of the twentieth century promoted panpsychist ideas, including:

F. S. C. Schiller: “A stone, no doubt, does not apprehend us as spiritual beings… But does this amount to saying that it does not apprehend us at all, and takes no note whatever of our existence? Not at all; it is aware of us and affected by us on the plane on which its own existence is passed… It faithfully exercises all the physical functions, and influences us by so doing. It gravitates and resists pressure, and obstructs…vibrations, and so forth, and makes itself respected as such a body. And it treats us as if of a like nature with itself, on the level of its understanding…” (1907: 442).
Samuel Alexander: “there is nothing dead, or senseless in the universe, [even] Space-Time itself being animated”(1920: 69).
John Dewey : “[T]here is nothing which marks off the plant from the physico-chemical activity of inanimate bodies. The latter also are subject to conditions of disturbed inner equilibrium, which lead to activity in relation to surrounding things, and which terminate after a cycle of changes…” (1925: 253).
Sir Arthur Eddington: “The stuff of the world is mind-stuff” (1928: 276).
J. B. S. Haldane: “We do not find obvious evidence of life or mind in so-called inert matter…; but if the scientific point of view is correct, we shall ultimately find them, at least in rudimentary form, all through the universe” (1932: 13).
J. Huxley: “[M]ind or something of the nature as mind must exist throughout the entire universe. This is, I believe, the truth” (1942: 141).
Teilhard de Chardin: “there is necessarily a double aspect to [matter’s] structure… [C]o-extensive with their Without, there is a Within to things.” “[W]e are logically forced to assume the existence in rudimentary form…of some sort of psyche in every corpuscle, even in those (the mega-molecules and below) whose complexity is of such a low or modest order as to render it (the psyche) imperceptible…” (1959: 56, 301).
C. H. Waddington: “[S]omething must go on in the simplest inanimate things which can be described in the same language as would be used to describe our self-awareness” (1961: 121).
Gregory Bateson: “The elementary cybernetic system with its messages in circuit is, in fact, the simplest unit of mind; … More complicated systems are perhaps more worthy to be called mental systems, but essentially this is what we are talking about. … We get a picture, then, of mind as synonymous with cybernetic system… [W]e know that within Mind in the widest sense there will be a hierarchy of subsystems, any one of which we can call an individual mind” (1972: 459-60).
Freeman Dyson: “The laws [of physics] leave a place for mind in the description of every molecule… In other words, mind is already inherent in every electron, and the processes of human consciousness differ only in degree and not in kind…” (1979: 249).
David Bohm: “That which we experience as mind…will in a natural way ultimately reach the level of the wavefunction and of the ‘dance’ of the particles. There is no unbridgeable gap or barrier between any of these levels. … It is implied that, in some sense, a rudimentary consciousness is present even at the level of particle physics” (1986: 131).

Panpsychism enters the 21^st century with vigor and diversity of thought. A number of recent works have focused attention on it. If we look back to the year 1996 we find two books that contributed to a resurrection of sorts. First, Chalmers’ The Conscious Mind lays out a naturalistic dualism theory of mind in which he suggests (with an apparent diffidence) that mind can be associated with ubiquitous information states—following Bateson and Bohm, though without citing their panpsychist views. His relatively detailed discussion of panpsychism sparked a resurgence of discussion on the matter, and contributed to a wider interest. Also, Abram’s Spell of the Sensuous argued from a phenomenological basis for a return to an animistic worldview, though his work was more poetic essay than detailed philosophical inquiry. In 1998 process philosopher David Ray Griffin published Unsnarling the World-Knot, a major milestone in panpsychist philosophy. Griffin supplies a detailed and scholarly assessment of the subject, though with a strong focus on the process view, and with only a cursory historical study.

Into the present century, Christian DeQuincey’s Radical Nature (2002) offers another process perspective, and a more satisfying review of the historical aspect. In 2003 there were two more books dedicated to panpsychism: David Clarke’s Panpsychism and the Religious Attitude, and Freya Mathews’ For Love of Matter. Clarke again takes the process view, underscoring the dominance of this philosophical perspective on the discussion. Mathews moves into new territory; drawing inspiration from Schopenhauer, she crafts a truly metaphysical philosophy in which humans are sensitive participants in an animate cosmos. Gregg Rosenberg released a nominally panpsychist approach to mind in 2004, with his book A Place for Consciousness. In 2005, Skrbina published the first-ever comprehensive study of the subject, Panpsychism in the West. Most recently, Galen Strawson has presented a forceful argument for panpsychism based on the inexplicability of emergence of mind (see Section 4).

Thus, at present we can discern at least six active lines of inquiry into panpsychism:

the Process Philosophy view, as conceived by Bergson and Whitehead, and developed by Hartshorne, Griffin, DeQuincey, and Clarke;
the Quantum Physics approach, as developed by Bohm, Hameroff, and others;
the Information Theory approach, arising from the work of Bateson, Wheeler (1994), Bohm, and Chalmers;
the Part-Whole Hierarchy, as envisioned by Cardano and elaborated by Koestler (1967) and Wilber (1995);
the Nonlinear Dynamics approach, as inspired by Peirce (1892) and further articulated by Skrbina (1994, 2001); and
Strawson’s (2006) “real physicalism” (see Section 4).

These areas all offer significant opportunity for development and articulation. They hold out the hope of resolving otherwise intractable problems of emergentism and mechanism, especially when so many conventional approaches have reached a dead end. As Nagel, Searle, and others have noted, the problems of mind and consciousness are so difficult that “drastic actions” are warranted—perhaps even as drastic as panpsychism.

Panpsychism, with its long list of advocates and sympathizers, is a robust and respectable approach to mind. It offers a naturalistic escape from Cartesian dualism and Christian theology. And, by undermining the mechanistic worldview, it promises to resolve not only long-standing philosophical problems but persistent social and ecological problems as well. Many great thinkers, from Empedocles and Epicurus to Campanella and LaMettrie, Fechner and James to Gregory Bateson, have recognized the potential for the panpsychist view to fundamentally alter, for the better, our outlook on the world. An animated worldview is not only philosophically rigorous, but it can have far-reaching and unanticipated effects.

3. Arguments: Pro and Con

An analysis of historical views, and recent discussions by such individuals as Griffin (1998), Popper (1977), McGinn (1997), and Seager (1995), demonstrate a number of distinct arguments for, and against, panpsychism. Skrbina (2005) identifies a total of six objections and twelve supporting arguments, though with some overlap between them. Below is a summary of the more compelling arguments and objections.

The first major argument for panpsychism is also one of the oldest: the Argument from Continuity. This argument, which is expressed in a variety of forms, claims that there is some critical thread of continuity among all things—a thread intimately related to the processes of mind. The particular entity that is continuous varies, but is typically expressed as either a substance or as a common form, structure, or function. We humans possess mind-like qualities that are a direct consequence of some substance, form, or structure; hence all things, to the degree that they share this common nature, have a corresponding share in mentality.

This is best illustrated through examples. The earliest such argument was presented by Anaximenes, with his arche of pneuma. As a kind of airy spirit, the pneuma accounted for our own minds but also permeated and sustained the entire cosmos and all things in it. Anaxagoras’ nous, and Heraclitus’ pyr, or fire, served a similar purpose, and thus were also arguments by continuity. Empedocles and Plato argued for pluralist, rather than monist, continuity. They saw all things as composed of the four elements (fire, air, water, and earth), and these elements were either souls in themselves (Empedocles), or the basis for human, cosmic, and other soul (Plato).

Among the German philosophers, Herder’s Kraft (force or power) played a similar role. For Schopenhauer, the will was our essential inner nature; since we are simply an “object among objects,” all things must possess an inner will. Fechner (1848/1946) emphasized the functional similarity between humans and, for example, plants. Though obviously different in many ways, living plants share essential functional qualities with humans, both representing a kind of living dynamism that suggests an inner striving and desire, a joy in being alive. Later, the American philosopher Dewey made a related case, stressing the continuity between living and nonliving systems.

At the heart of these arguments is an attempt to draw a fundamental analogy between humans and nonhumans. Some philosophers prefer to call such arguments “analogical,” and for good reason. But this is not sufficiently precise. Nearly every conceivable argument for panpsychism must start from the fact of our own human mind, and draw some analogy from that. It is the nature of the analogy that distinguishes the arguments. The continuity arguments are one particular form of analogical thinking, and hence deserve special designation.

In order to oppose an argument by continuity, one must either refute the existence of the substance or structure, or deny that it relates to mind in any fundamental way—the latter being the more common approach. The critic may argue that the continuity analogy simply fails to hold; hence we have the Inconclusive Analogy objection. Such a critic typically would take the extreme cases of a human versus a rock or an atom, and argue that no relevant analogy can be made. But of course, what seems obvious in the extreme cases is less so when one examines the intermediate points; it is there that the critic has to make his case.

A second general argument for panpsychism, also dating back to ancient Greece, relates to the notion of emergence of mind. The Greeks developed the idea that ex nihilo, nihil fit: out of nothing comes nothing. We thus get the argument that mind cannot arise from no-mind, and hence that mind must have been present at the very origin of things. This is the Argument from Non-Emergence. An extended treatment follows in Section 4.

The Non-Emergence Argument is countered by claiming, naturally, that emergence of mind is in fact intelligible and explicable (this is the majority view, but no philosopher to date has succeeded in giving a widely-accepted explanation for it). Popper (1977) was perhaps the first to use emergence as an objection to panpsychism, but recently an entire volume was dedicated to this topic; see Strawson, et al (2006).

With the advent of Darwin’s theory of evolution in the mid-1800’s there came new support for both continuity and non-emergence arguments. If humans evolved from lower animals, they from single-celled creatures, and they in turn from nonliving matter, then the continuity of beings suggests a continuity of the fundamental qualities of experience, awareness, and mind. Evolutionary continuity over time makes difficult any attempt to define the supposed point in history at which mind suddenly appeared. Haeckel (1892) was the first to offer an evolutionary argument, but Paulsen, Royce, Waddington, and Rensch made essentially the same claim.

Others expressed it differently. There is, they said, no place within the hierarchy of organism complexity—the so-called phylogenetic chain—where one can “draw a line” to distinguish those with mind from those without. Clifford (1874) was perhaps the first to put it this way:

[I]t is impossible for anybody to point out the particular place…where [absence of consciousness] can be supposed to have taken place. […] [E]ven in the very lowest organisms, even in the Amoeba…there is something or other, inconceivably simple to us, which is of the same nature with our own consciousness… [Furthermore] we cannot stop at organic matter, [but] we are obliged to assume…that along with every motion of matter, whether organic or inorganic, there is some fact which corresponds to the mental fact in ourselves (pp. 60-61).

Others, including Globus, Chalmers (1996), and Rensch, have argued in similar terms.

To counter this argument one must identify a plausible point at which to break the hierarchical chain. Where, and why, does the continuity suddenly fail to hold? All agree that it holds, to some degree, for higher mammals, such as chimpanzees and dolphins. If the critic believes it to fail with rocks and atoms, he must explain this discrepancy—otherwise the objection is invalid. To date few have attempted this. Tye (2000: 171) is one exception; he draws the line at fish and honey bees, which, he says, are the simplest beings that experience a kind of “phenomenal consciousness.” Whether his rationale for this line is acceptable is an open question.

Two final objections bear mentioning. First is the Not Testable, or No Signs, objection: there is no empirical evidence, nor any conceivable test, that could point to the presence of mind in lesser beings. McGinn (1997) and Seager (1995) have raised this point, among others. Yet it is hard to see what might actually count as valid evidence of mind. As Royce and Peirce have observed, simpler minds may appear to us as law-like phenomena. Analogy and rational thinking about metaphysical continuity are all we have to go on. Given the conceptual difficulty in determining, with certainty, the existence of minds in other human beings, one should not be surprised that definitive evidence of lesser minds is lacking. Certainly there is, we may say, an epistemological gap here, in that our knowledge is deficient; but this does not imply an ontological gap, that is, an absence of mind in other things.

Lastly we have the Combination Problem: If mind is supposed to exist in atoms or cells, then higher-order minds, such as humans have, must be some kind of combination or sum of these lesser minds. But it is inconceivable how such a summing would work and how it might account for the richness of experience that we all feel. Because panpsychism cannot account for higher mind, the objector says, it must be false.

We should first note that this is not an objection to panpsychism per se, but only to the particular theory that says that higher-order mind must be composed of lower-order mental elements. Granting this, there remains the general question of the relation between higher- and lower-order minds within the same being. As such, the Combination Problem may be better seen as a call for details.

The problem was first addressed by Leibniz in the late 1600’s. His panpsychist theory of monads allowed for a single dominant monad to unify the collective, and serve as the mind of the body. Kant, in an early work Dreams of a Spirit-Seer, criticized Leibniz’s theory and thus became the first to employ the Combination Problem against panpsychism. In 1890 William James raised the issue, in objection to Clifford’s “mind-stuff” form of panpsychism—though by 1909 he had changed his mind, and stopped viewing combination as an insurmountable hurdle. More recently Seager (1995) highlights the combination problem as one of particular importance, as do a number of contributors to Strawson, et al (2006).

4. Panpsychism vs. Emergentism

The issue of emergence of mind is important because it is the mutually exclusive counterpart to panpsychism: either you are a panpsychist, or you are an emergentist. Either mind was present in things from the very beginning or it appeared (emerged) at some point in the history of evolution. If, however, emergence is inexplicable, or is less viable, then one is left with the panpsychist alternative. This line of reasoning, as mentioned above, is the argument from Non-Emergence.

To briefly recap the historical forms of this argument: it was first formulated by Epicurus circa 300 B.C.E. As we have seen, he argued that the mental quality called will could not arise from non-will, and therefore that the atoms from which everything was made had to possess a kind of will themselves. Will cannot emerge ex nihilo, and thus is present in the very constituents of matter.

Others were likewise convinced by this approach. Telesio held that “nothing can give what it does not possess,” and thus it is inconceivable that mind arises from no-mind. Patrizi believed, similarly, that nothing can be in the effect that is not in the cause; hence, the elements themselves must have life and soul, which they in turn grant to all things. In 1620 Campanella wrote: “If the animals are sentient…and sentience does not come from nothing, the elements whereby they and everything else are brought into being must be said to be sentient, because what the result has the cause must have” (in Dooley, 1995: 39).

The German panpsychists also found this argument compelling. Fechner argued that “animate beings cannot arise from inanimate.” Paulsen examined the question, “Whence did psychical life arise?” His answer: it did not arise, but was present at the origin of things. The sudden appearance of a mental realm “would be an absolute world-riddle; it would mean a creation out of nothing” (1892: 100).

The Non-Emergence argument resurfaced in the late twentieth century with the work of zoologist Sewall Wright. In his 1977 article “Panpsychism and Science” he argued that brute emergence of mind would be a kind of inexplicable miracle in the natural order of things: “Emergence of mind from no mind at all is sheer magic” (p. 82). Thomas Nagel flirted with this argument in his “Panpsychism” essay (1979), but opted not to follow through on all the implications.

The basic problem is this: emergence seems, at first glance, to be a reasonable enough idea, but when pressed for details it comes up sorely lacking. In fact, emergence of mind is very difficult to sensibly explain. Mind is not like five-fingered-ness, or warm-bloodedness. These things, which clearly did emerge, are ontologically unlike mind. They are simply reconfigurations of existing physical matter, whereas mind is of a different ontological order. It is too fundamental an aspect of existence to be comparable to ordinary biological structural features.

Furthermore, emergence of mind is not just some fact of the distant evolutionary past; it must recur every day, in, for example, the development of a human embryo. That is, if a human egg is utterly without mind, and a newborn infant has one, when in the ontogenetic process does mind emerge? Why just there? So in addition to the phylogenetic (historical) emergence problem, we have the related ontogenetic problem as well.

Given that there are very few panpsychists in the world, most everyone is an emergentist. But, as Galen Strawson (2006) has recently emphasized, emergentism is not a forgone conclusion. In fact, it is highly dubious. His piece “Realistic Monism: Why Physicalism Entails Panpsychism” presses this point with notable urgency, and offers the most detailed and complete version of the Non-Emergence argument to date. If one is not a panpsychist, then one necessarily believes that only some subset of creatures is privileged to possess mind. The vast remainder of nature, then, is utterly non-mental. This, Strawson observes, is pure presumption: “there is absolutely no evidence whatsoever” (p. 20) for a non-mental component of reality. We simply assume it to be so.

Strawson’s argument, in a nutshell, is this:

There is one ultimate reality to the universe (“realistic physicalism,” as he calls it).
Mental (that is, experiential) phenomena are a part of this monistic reality. Therefore, experiential phenomena are physical phenomena, rightly understood.
Radical-kind, or brute, emergence is impossible; mental phenomena cannot arise from any purely non-mental stuff.
Therefore, the one reality and all things in it are necessarily experiential.

If we are to be physicalists, Strawson says, then let us be real physicalists and take the implications seriously. When we do so, we find that “something akin to panpsychism is not merely one possible form of realistic physicalism, but the only possible form, and hence, the only possible form of physicalism tout court” (p. 9).

Strawson tackles head-on those who implicitly endorse emergence. He asks, “Does this conception of emergence make sense? I think that it is very, very hard to understand what it is supposed to involve. I think that it is incoherent, in fact, and that this general way of talking of emergence has acquired an air of plausibility…for some simply because it has been appealed to many times in the face of a seeming mystery” (p. 12). He gives a number of examples of putative emergence, showing that each is really unintelligible. His slogan: “emergence can’t be brute,” that is, higher-order mind can emerge from lower-order, but mind cannot possibly emerge from no-mind. “Brute emergence is by definition a miracle every time it occurs,” which is rationally inconceivable.

Panpsychism thus offers a kind of resolution to the problem of emergence, and is supported by several other arguments as well. The viability of panpsychism is no longer really in question. At issue is the specific form it might take, and what its implications are. Panpsychism suggests a radically different worldview, one that is fundamentally at odds with the dominant mechanistic conception of the universe. Arguably, it is precisely this mechanistic view—which sees the universe and everything in it as a kind of giant machine—that lies at the root of many of our philosophical, sociological, and environmental problems. Panpsychism, by challenging this worldview at its root, potentially offers new solutions to some very old problems.

5. References and Further Reading

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Cassirer, E. 1927/1963. The Individual and the Cosmos in Renaissance Philosophy. Trans. M. Domandi. New York: Barnes and Nobel.
Chalmers, D. 1996. The Conscious Mind. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
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Author Information

David Skrbina
Email: skrbina@umd.umich.edu
University of Michigan at Dearborn
U. S. A.

Model-Theoretic Conceptions of
Logical Consequence

One sentence X is said to be a logical consequence of a set K of sentences, if and only if, in virtue of logic alone, it is impossible for all the sentences in the set to be true without X being true as well. One well-known specification of this informal characterization is the model-theoretic conception of logical consequence: a sentence X is a logical consequence of a set K of sentences if and only if all models of K are models of X. The model-theoretic characterization is a theoretical definition of logical consequence. It has been argued that this conception of logical consequence is more basic than the characterization in terms of deducibility in a deductive system. The correctness of the model-theoretic characterization of logical consequence, and the adequacy of the notion of a logical constant it utilizes are matters of contemporary debate.

Introduction
Linguistic Preliminaries: the Language M
1. Syntax of M
2. Semantics for M
What is a Logic?
Model-Theoretic Consequence
The Status of the Model-Theoretic Characterization of Logical Consequence
Conclusion
References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

One sentence X is said to be a logical consequence of a set of sentences, if and only if, in virtue of logic alone, it is impossible for all the sentences in K to be true without X being true as well. One well-known specification of this informal characterization, due to Tarski (1936), is: X is a logical consequence of K if and only if there is no possible interpretation of the non-logical terminology of the language L according to which all the sentences in K are true and X is false. A possible interpretation of the non-logical terminology of L according to which sentences are true or false is a reading of the non-logical terms according to which the sentences receive a truth-value (that is, are either true or false) in a situation that is not ruled out by the semantic properties of the logical constants. The philosophical locus of the technical development of ‘possible interpretation’ in terms of models is Tarski (1936). A model for a language L is the theoretical development of a possible interpretation of non-logical terminology of L according to which the sentences of L receive a truth-value. The characterization of logical consequence in terms of models is called the Tarskian or model-theoretic characterization of logical consequence. It may be stated as follows.

X is a logical consequence of K if and only if all models of K are models of X.

See the entry, Logical Consequence, Philosophical Considerations, for discussion of Tarski’s development of the model-theoretic characterization of logical consequence in light of the ordinary conception.

We begin by giving an interpreted language M. Next, logical consequence is defined model-theoretically. Finally, the status of this characterization is discussed, and criticisms of it are entertained.

2. Linguistic Preliminaries: the Language M

Here we define a simple language M, a language about the McKeon family, by first sketching what strings qualify as well-formed formulas (wffs) in M. Next we define sentences from formulas, and then give an account of truth in M, that is we describe the conditions in which M-sentences are true.

a. Syntax of M

Building blocks of formulas

Terms

Individual names—’beth’, ‘kelly’, ‘matt’, ‘paige’, ‘shannon’, ‘evan’, and ‘w₁‘, ‘w₂‘, ‘w₃‘, etc.

Variables—’x’, ‘y’, ‘z’, ‘x₁‘, ‘y₁‘, ‘z₁‘, ‘x₂‘, ‘y₂‘, ‘z₂‘, etc.

Predicates

1-place predicates—’Female’, ‘Male’

2-place predicates—’Parent’, ‘Brother’, ‘Sister’, ‘Married’, ‘OlderThan’, ‘Admires’, ‘=’.

Blueprints of well-formed formulas (wffs)

Atomic formulas: An atomic wff is any of the above n-place predicates followed by n terms which are enclosed in parentheses and separated by commas.

Formulas: The general notion of a well-formed formula (wff) is defined recursively as follows:

(1) All atomic wffs are wffs.
(2) If α is a wff, so is ~α.
(3) If α and β are wffs, so is (α & β).
(4) If α and β are wffs, so is (α v β).
(5) If α and β are wffs, so is (α → β).
(6) If Ψ is a wff and v is a variable, then ∃vΨ is a wff.
(7) If Ψ is a wff and v is a variable, then ∀vΨ is a wff.
Finally, no string of symbols is a well-formed formula of M unless the string can be derived from (1)-(7).

The signs ‘~’, ‘&’, ‘v‘, and ‘→’, are called sentential connectives. The signs ‘∀’ and ‘∃’ are called quantifiers.

It will prove convenient to have available in M an infinite number of individual names as well as variables. The strings ‘Parent(beth, paige)’ and ‘Male(x)’ are examples of atomic wffs. We allow the identity symbol in an atomic formula to occur in between two terms, e.g., instead of ‘=(evan, evan)’ we allow ‘(evan = evan)’. The symbols ‘~’, ‘&’, ‘v‘, and ‘→’ correspond to the English words ‘not’, ‘and’, ‘or’ and ‘if…then’, respectively. ‘∃’ is our symbol for an existential quantifier and ‘∀’ represents the universal quantifier. ∃vΨ and ∀vΨ correspond to for some v, Ψ, and for all v, Ψ, respectively. For every quantifier, its scope is the smallest part of the wff in which it is contained that is itself a wff. An occurrence of a variable v is a bound occurrence iff it is in the scope of some quantifier of the form ∃v or the form ∀v, and is free otherwise. For example, the occurrence of ‘x’ is free in ‘Male(x)’ and in ‘∃y Married(y, x)’. The occurrences of ‘y’ in the second formula are bound because they are in the scope of the existential quantifier. A wff with at least one free variable is an open wff, and a closed formula is one with no free variables. A sentence is a closed wff. For example, ‘Female(kelly)’ and ‘∃y∃x Married(y, x)’ are sentences but ‘OlderThan(kelly, y)’ and ‘(∃x Male(x) & Female(z))’ are not. So, not all of the wffs of M are sentences. As noted below, this will affect our definition of truth for M.

b. Semantics for M

We now provide a semantics for M. This is done in two steps. First, we specify a domain of discourse, that is, the chunk of the world that our language M is about, and interpret M’s predicates and names in terms of the elements composing the domain. Then we state the conditions under which each type of M-sentence is true. To each of the above syntactic rules (1-7) there corresponds a semantic rule that stipulates the conditions in which the sentence constructed using the syntactic rule is true. The principle of bivalence is assumed and so ‘not true’ and ‘false’ are used interchangeably. In effect, the interpretation of M determines a truth-value (true, false) for each and every sentence of M.

Domain D—The McKeons: Matt, Beth, Shannon, Kelly, Paige, and Evan.

Here are the referents and extensions of the names and predicates of M.

Terms: ‘matt’ refers to Matt, ‘beth’ refers to Beth, ‘shannon’ refers to Shannon, etc.

Predicates. The meaning of a predicate is identified with its extension, that is the set (possibly empty) of elements from the domain D the predicate is true of. The extension of a one-place predicate is a set of elements from D, the extension of a two-place predicate is a set of ordered pairs of elements from D.

The extension of ‘Male’ is {Matt, Evan}.

The extension of ‘Female’ is {Beth, Shannon, Kelly, Paige}.

The extension of ‘Parent’ is {<Matt, Shannon>, <Matt, Kelly>, <Matt, Paige>, <Matt, Evan>, <Beth, Shannon>, <Beth, Kelly>, <Beth, Paige>, <Beth, Evan>}.

The extension of ‘Married’ is {<Matt, Beth>, <Beth, Matt>}.

The extension of ‘Sister’ is {<Shannon, Kelly>, <Kelly, Shannon>, <Shannon, Paige>, <Paige, Shannon>, <Kelly, Paige>, <Paige, Kelly>, <Kelly, Evan>, <Paige, Evan>, <Shannon, Evan>}.

The extension of ‘Brother’ is {<Evan, Shannon>, <Evan, Kelly>, <Evan, Paige>}.

The extension of ‘OlderThan’ is {<Beth, Matt>, <Beth, Shannon>, <Beth, Kelly>, <Beth, Paige>, <Beth, Evan>, <Matt, Shannon>, <Matt, Kelly>, <Matt, Paige>, <Matt, Evan>, <Shannon, Kelly>, <Shannon, Paige>, <Shannon, Evan>, <Kelly, Paige>, <Kelly, Evan>, <Paige, Evan>}.

The extension of ‘Admires’ is {<Matt, Beth>, <Shannon, Matt>, <Shannon, Beth>, <Kelly, Beth>, <Kelly, Matt>, <Kelly, Shannon>, <Paige, Beth>, <Paige, Matt>, <Paige, Shannon>, <Paige, Kelly>, <Evan, Beth>, <Evan, Matt>, <Evan, Shannon>, <Evan, Kelly>, <Evan, Paige>}.

The extension of ‘=’ is {<Matt, Matt>, <Beth, Beth>, <Shannon, Shannon>, <Kelly, Kelly>, <Paige, Paige>, <Evan, Evan>}.

(I)

An atomic sentence with a one-place predicate is true iff the referent of the term is a member of the extension of the predicate, and an atomic sentence with a two-place predicate is true iff the ordered pair formed from the referents of the terms in order is a member of the extension of the predicate.

The atomic sentence ‘Female(kelly)’ is true because, as indicated above, the referent of ‘kelly’ is in the extension of the property designated by ‘Female’. The atomic sentence ‘Married(shannon, kelly)’ is false because the ordered pair <Shannon, Kelly> is not in the extension of the relation designated by ‘Married’.

Let α and β be any M-sentences.

(II)	~α is true iff α is false.
(III)	(α & β) is true when both α and β are true; otherwise (α & β) is false.
(IV)	(α v β) is true when at least one of α and β is true; otherwise (α v β) is false.
(V)	(α → β) is true if and only if (iff) α is false or β is true. So, (α → β) is false just in case α is true and β is false.

The meanings for ‘~’ and ‘&’ roughly correspond to the meanings of ‘not’ and ‘and’ as ordinarily used. We call ~α and (α & β) negation and conjunction formulas, respectively. The formula (~α v β) is called a disjunction and the meaning of ‘v‘ corresponds to inclusive or. There are a variety of conditionals in English (e.g., causal, counterfactual, logical), each type having a distinct meaning. The conditional defined by (V) above is called the material conditional. One way of following (V) is to see that the truth conditions for (α → β) are the same as for ~(α & ~β).

By (II) ‘~Married(shannon, kelly)’ is true because, as noted above, ‘Married(shannon, kelly)’ is false. (II) also tells us that ‘~Female(kelly)’ is false since ‘Female(kelly)’ is true. According to (III), ‘(~Married(shannon, kelly) & Female(kelly))’ is true because ‘~Married(shannon, kelly)’ is true and ‘Female(kelly)’ is true. And ‘(Male(shannon) & Female(shannon))’ is false because ‘Male(shannon)’ is false. (IV) confirms that ‘(Female(kelly) v Married(evan, evan))’ is true because, even though ‘Married(evan, evan)’ is false, ‘Female(kelly)’ is true. From (V) we know that the sentence ‘(~(beth = beth) → Male(shannon))’ is true because ‘~(beth = beth)’ is false. If α is false then (α → β) is true regardless of whether or not β is true. The sentence ‘(Female(beth) → Male(shannon))’ is false because ‘Female(beth)’ is true and ‘Male(shannon)’ is false.

Before describing the truth conditions for quantified sentences we need to say something about the notion of satisfaction. We’ve defined truth only for the formulas of M that are sentences. So, the notions of truth and falsity are not applicable to non-sentences such as ‘Male(x)’ and ‘((x = x) → Female(x))’ in which ‘x’ occurs free. However, objects may satisfy wffs that are non-sentences. We introduce the notion of satisfaction with some examples. An object satisfies ‘Male(x)’ just in case that object is male. Matt satisfies ‘Male(x)’, Beth does not. This is the case because replacing ‘x’ in ‘Male(x)’ with ‘matt’ yields a truth while replacing the variable with ‘beth’ yields a falsehood. An object satisfies ‘((x = x) → Female(x))’ if and only if it is either not identical with itself or is a female. Beth satisfies this wff (we get a truth when ‘beth’ is substituted for the variable in all of its occurrences), Matt does not (putting ‘matt’ in for ‘x’ wherever it occurs results in a falsehood). As a first approximation, we say that an object with a name, say ‘a’, satisfies a wff Ψv in which at most v occurs free if and only if the sentence that results by replacing v in all of its occurrences with ‘a’ is true. ‘Male(x)’ is neither true nor false because it is not a sentence, but it is either satisfiable or not by a given object. Now we define the truth conditions for quantifications, utilizing the notion of satisfaction. The notion of satisfaction will be revisited below when we formalize the semantics for M and give the model-theoretic characterization of logical consequence.

Let Ψ be any formula of M in which at most v occurs free.

(VI)	∃vΨ is true just in case there is at least one individual in the domain of quantification (e.g. at least one McKeon) that satisfies Ψ.
(VII)	∀vΨ is true just in case every individual in the domain of quantification (e.g. every McKeon) satisfies Ψ.

Here are some examples. ‘∃x(Male(x) & Married(x, beth))’ is true because Matt satisfies ‘(Male(x) & Married(x, beth))’; replacing ‘x’ wherever it appears in the wff with ‘matt’ results in a true sentence. The sentence ‘∃xOlderThan(x, x)’ is false because no McKeon satisfies ‘OlderThan(x, x)’, that is replacing ‘x’ in ‘OlderThan(x, x)’ with the name of a McKeon always yields a falsehood.

The universal quantification ‘∀x( OlderThan(x, paige) → Male(x))’ is false for there is a McKeon who doesn’t satisfy ‘(OlderThan(x, paige) → Male(x))’. For example, Shannon does not satisfy ‘(OlderThan(x, paige) → Male(x))’ because Shannon satisfies ‘OlderThan(x, paige)’ but not ‘Male(x)’. The sentence ‘∀x(x = x)’ is true because all McKeons satisfy ‘x = x’; replacing ‘x’ with the name of any McKeon results in a true sentence.

Note that in the explanation of satisfaction we suppose that an object satisfies a wff only if the object is named. But we don’t want to presuppose that all objects in the domain of discourse are named. For the purposes of an example, suppose that the McKeons adopt a baby boy, but haven’t named him yet. Then, ‘∃x Brother(x, evan)’ is true because the adopted child satisfies ‘Brother(x, evan)’, even though we can’t replace ‘x’ with the child’s name to get a truth. To get around this is easy enough. We have added a list of names, ‘w₁‘, ‘w₂‘, ‘w₃‘, etc., to M, and we may say that any unnamed object satisfies Ψv iff the replacement of v with a previously unused w_i assigned as a name of this object results in a true sentence. In the above scenerio, ‘∃xBrother(x, evan)’ is true because, ultimately, treating ‘w₁‘ as a temporary name of the child, ‘Brother(w₁, evan)’ is true. Of course, the meanings of the predicates would have to be amended in order to reflect the addition of a new person to the domain of McKeons.

3. What is a Logic?

We have characterized an interpreted formal language M by defining what qualifies as a sentence of M and by specifying the conditions under which any M-sentence is true. The received view of logical consequence entails that the logical consequence relation in M turns on the nature of the logical constants in the relevant M-sentences. We shall regard just the sentential connectives, the quantifiers of M, and the identity predicate as logical constants (the language M is a first-order language). For discussion of the notion of a logical constant see Section 5c below.

At the start of this article, it is said that a sentence X is a logical consequence of a set K of sentences, if and only if, in virtue of logic alone, it is impossible for all the sentences in K to be true without X being true as well. A model-theoretic conception of logical consequence in language M clarifies this intuitive characterization of logical consequence by appealing to the semantic properties of the logical constants, represented in the above truth clauses (I)-(VII). In contrast, a deductive-theoretic conception clarifies logical consequence in M, conceived of in terms of deducibility, by appealing to the inferential properties of logical constants portrayed as intuitively valid principles of inference, that is, principles justifying steps in deductions. See Logical Consequence, Deductive-Theoretic Conceptions for a deductive-theoretic characterization of logical consequence in terms of a deductive system, and for a discussion on the relationship between the logical consequence relation and the model-theoretic and deductive-theoretic conceptions of it.

Following Shapiro (1991, p. 3), we define a logic to be a formal language L plus either a model-theoretic or a deductive-theoretic account of logical consequence. A language with both characterizations is a full logic just in case the two characterizations coincide. The logic for M developed below may be viewed as a classical logic or a first-order theory.

4. Model-Theoretic Consequence

The technical machinery to follow is designed to clarify how it is that sentences receive truth-values owing to interpretations of them. We begin by introducing the notion of a structure. Then we revisit the notion of satisfaction in order to make it more precise, and link structures and satisfaction to model-theoretic consequence. We offer a modernized version of the model-theoretic characterization of logical consequence sketched by Tarski and so deviate from the details of Tarski’s presentation in his (1936).

a. Truth in a structure

Relative to our language M, a structure U is an ordered pair <D, I>.

(1)	D, a non-empty set of elements, is the domain of discourse. Two things to highlight here. First, the domain D of a structure for M may be any set of entities, e.g. the dogs living in Connecticut, the toothbrushes on Earth, the natural numbers, the twelve apostles, etc. Second, we require that D not be the empty set.

(2)	I is a function that assigns to each individual constant of M an element of D, and to each n-place predicate of M a subset of Dⁿ (that is, the set of n-tuples taken from D). In essence, I interprets the individual constants and predicates of M, linking them to elements and sets of n-tuples of elements from of D. For individual constants c and predicates P, the element I_U(c) is the element of D designated by c under I_U, and I_U(P) is the set of entities assigned by I_U as the extension of P.

By ‘structure’ we mean an L-structure for some first-order language L. The intended structure for a language L is the course-grained representation of the piece of the world that we intend L to be about. The intended domain D and its subsets represent the chunk of the world L is being used to talk about and quantify over. The intended interpretation of L’s constants and predicates assigns the actual denotations to L’s constants and the actual extensions to the predicates. The above semantics for our language M, may be viewed, in part, as an informal portrayal of the intended structure of M, which we refer to as U^M. That is, we take M to be a tool for talking about the McKeon family with respect to gender, who is older than whom, who admires whom, etc. To make things formally prim and proper we should represent the interpretation of constants as I_UM(matt) = Matt, I_UM(beth) = Beth, and so on. And the interpretation of predicates can look like I_UM(Male) = {Matt, Evan}, I_UM(Female) = {Beth, Shannon, Kelly, Paige}, and so on. We assume that this has been done.

A structure U for a language L (that is, an L-structure) represents one way that a language can be used to talk about a state of affairs. Crudely, the domain D and the subsets recovered from D constitute a rudimentary representation of a state of affairs, and the interpretation of L’s predicates and individual constants makes the language L about the relevant state of affairs. Since a language can be assigned different structures, it can be used to talk about different states of affairs. The class of L-structures represents all the states of affairs that the language L can be used to talk about. For example, consider the following M-structure U’.

D = the set of natural numbers

I_U’(beth) = 2
I_U’(matt) = 3
I_U’(shannon) = 5
I_U’(kelly) = 7
I_U’(paige) = 11
I_U’(evan) = 10 I_U’(Male) = {d ∈ D | d is prime}
I_U’(Female) = {d ∈ D | d is even}
I_U’(Parent) = ∅
I_U’(Married) = {<d, d’> ∈ D² | d + 1 = d’ }
I_U’(Sister) = ∅
I_U’(Brother) = {<d, d’> ∈ D² | d < d’ }
I_U’(OlderThan) = {<d, d’> ∈ D² | d > d’ }
I_U’(Admires) = ∅
I_U’(=) = {<d, d’> ∈ D² | d = d’ }

In specifying the domain D and the values of the interpretation function defined on M’s predicates we make use of brace notation, instead of the earlier list notation, to pick out sets. For example, we write

{d ∈ D | d is even}

to say “the set of all elements d of D such that d is even.” And

{<d, d’> ∈ D² | d > d’}

reads: “The set of ordered pairs of elements d, d’ of D such that d > d’.” Consider: the sentence

OlderThan(beth, matt)

is true in the intended structure U^M for <I_UM(beth), I_UM(matt)> is in I_UM(OlderThan). But the sentence is false in U’ for <I_U’(beth), I_U’(matt)> is not in I_U’(OlderThan) (because 2 is not greater than 3). The sentence

(Female(beth) & Male(beth))

is not true in U^M but is true in U’ for I_U’(beth) is in I_U’(Female) and in I_U’(Male) (because 2 is an even prime). In order to avoid confusion it is worth highlighting that when we say that the sentence ‘(Female(beth) & Male(beth))’ is true in one structure and false in another we are saying that one and the same wff with no free variables is true in one state of affairs on an interpretation and false in another state of affairs on another interpretation.

b. Satisfaction revisited

Note the general strategy of giving the semantics of the sentential connectives: the truth of a compound sentence formed with any of them is determined by its component well-formed formulas (wffs), which are themselves (simpler) sentences. However, this strategy needs to be altered when it comes to quantificational sentences. For quantificational sentences are built out of open wffs and, as noted above, these component wffs do not admit of truth and falsity. Therefore, we can’t think of the truth of, say,

∃x(Female(x) & OlderThan(x, paige))

in terms of the truth of ‘(Female(x) & OlderThan(x, paige))’ for some McKeon x. What we need is a truth-relevant property of open formulas that we may appeal to in explaining the truth-value of the compound quantifications formed from them. Tarski is credited with the solution, first hinted at in the following.

The possibility suggests itself, however, of introducing a more general concept which is applicable to any sentential function [open or closed wff] can be recursively defined, and, when applied to sentences leads us directly to the concept of truth. These requirements are met by the notion of satisfaction of a given sentential function by given objects. (Tarski 1933, p. 189)

The needed property is satisfaction. The truth of the above existential quantification will depend on there being an object that satisfies both ‘Female(x)’ and ‘OlderThan(x, paige)’. Earlier we introduced the concept of satisfaction by describing the conditions in which one element satisfies an open formula with one free variable. Now we want to develop a picture of what it means for objects to satisfy a wff with n free variables for any n ≥ 0. We begin by introducing the notion of a variable assignment.

A variable assignment is a function g from a set of variables (its domain) to a set of objects (its range). We shall say that the variable assignment g is suitable for a well-formed formula (wff) Ψ of M if every free variable in Ψ is in the domain of g. In order for a variable assignment to satisfy a wff it must be suitable for the formula. For a variable assignment g that is suitable for Ψ, g satisfies Ψ in U iff the object(s) g assigns to the free variable(s) in Ψ satisfy Ψ. Unlike the earlier first-step characterization of satisfaction, there is no appeal to names for the entities assigned to the variables. This has the advantage of not requiring that new names be added to a language that does not have names for everything in the domain. In specifying a variable assignment g, we write α/v, β/v’, χ/v”, … to indicate that g(v) = α, g(v’ ) = β, g(v” ) = χ, etc. We understand

U ⊨ Ψ[g]

to mean that g satisfies Ψ in U.

U^M ⊨ OlderThan(x, y)[Shannon/x, Paige/y]

This is true: the variable assignment g, identified with [Shannon/x, Paige/y], satisfies ‘Olderthan(x, y)’ because Shannon is older than Paige.

U^M ⊨ Admires(x, y)[Beth/x, Matt/y]

This is false for this variable assignment does not satisfy the wff: Beth does not admire Matt. However, the following is true because Matt admires Beth.

U^M ⊨ Admires(x, y)[Matt/x, Beth/y]

For any wff Ψ, a suitable variable assignment g and structure U together ensure that the terms in Ψ designate elements in D. The structure U insures that individual constants have referents, and the assignment g insures that any free variables in Ψ get denotations. For any individual constant c, c[g] is the element I_U(c). For each variable v, and assignment g whose domain contains v, v[g] is the element g(v). In effect, the variable assignment treats the variable v as a temporary name. We define t[g] as ‘the element designated by t relative to the assignment g’.

c. A formalized definition of truth for Language M

We now give a definition of truth for the language M via the detour through satisfaction. The goal is to define for each formula α of M and each assignment g to the free variables, if any, of α in U what must obtain in order for U ⊨ α[g].

(I)	Where R is an n-place predicate and t₁, …, t_n are terms, U ⊨R(t₁, …, t_n)[g] if and only if (iff) the n-tuple <t₁[g], …, t_n[g]> is in I_U(R).

(II)	U ⊨ ~α[g] iff it is not true that U ⊨ α[g].

(III)	U ⊨ (α & β)[g] iff U ⊨ α[g] and U ⊨ β[g].

(IV)	U ⊨ (α v β)[g] iff U ⊨ α[g] or U ⊨ β[g].

(V)	U ⊨ (α → β)[g] iff either it is not true that U ⊨ α[g] or U ⊨ β[g].

Before going on to the (VI) and (VII) clauses for quantificational sentences, it is worthwhile to introduce the notion of a variable assignment that comes from another. Consider

∃y(Female(x) & OlderThan(x, y)).

We want to say that a variable assignment g satisfies this wff if and only if there is a variable assignment g’ differing from g at most with regard to the object it assigns to the variable y such that g’ satisfies ‘(Female(x) & OlderThan(x, y))’. We say that a variable assignment g’ comes from an assignment g when the domain of g’ is that of g and a variable v, and g’ assigns the same values as g with the possible exception of the element g’ assigns to v. In general, we represent an extension g’ of an assignment g as follows.

[g, d/v]

This picks out a variable assignment g’ which differs at most from g in that v is in its domain and g'(v) = d, for some element d of the domain D. So, it is true that

U^M ⊨∃y(Female(x) & OlderThan(x, y)) [Beth/x]

since

U^M ⊨ (Female(x) & OlderThan(x, y)) [Beth/x, Paige/y].

What this says is that the variable assignment that comes from the assignment of Beth to ‘x’ by adding the assignment of Paige to ‘y’ satisfies ‘(Female(x) & OlderThan(x, y))’ in U^M. This is true for Beth is a female who is older than Paige. Now we give the satisfaction clauses for quantificational sentences. Let Ψ be any formula of M.

(VI)	U ⊨∃vΨ[g] iff for at least one element d of D, U ⊨ Ψ[g, d/v].

(VII)	U ⊨ ∀vΨ[g] iff for all elements d of D, U ⊨ Ψ[g, d/v].

If α is a sentence, then it has no free variables and we write U ⊨ α[g_∅] which says that the empty variable assignment satisfies α in U. The empty variable assignment g_∅ does not assign objects to any variables. In short: the definition of truth for language L is

A sentence α is true in U if and only if U ⊨ α[g_∅], that is the empty variable assignment satisfies α in U.

The truth definition specifies the conditions in which a formula of M is true in a structure by explaining how the semantic properties of any formula of M are determined by its construction from semantically primitive expressions (e.g., predicates, individual constants, and variables) whose semantic properties are specified directly. If every member of a set of sentences is true in a structure U we say that U is a model of the set. We now work through some examples. The reader will be aided by referring when needed to the clauses (I)-(VII).

It is true that U^M ⊨ ~Married(kelly, kelly))[g_∅], that is, by (II) it is not true that U^M ⊨ Married(kelly, kelly))[g_∅], because <kelly[g_∅], kelly[g_∅]> is not in I_UM(Married). Hence, by (IV)

U^M ⊨ (Married(shannon, kelly) v ~Married(kelly, kelly))[g_∅].

Our truth definition should confirm that

∃x∃y Admires(x, y)

is true in U^M. Note that by (VI) U^M ⊨∃yAdmires(x, y)[g_∅, Paige/x] since U^M ⊨ Admires(x, y)[g_∅, Paige/x, kelly/y]. Hence, by (VI)

U^M ⊨∃x∃y Admires(x, y)[g_∅] .

The sentence, ‘∀x∃y(Older(y, x) → Admires(x, y))’ is true in U^M . By (VII) we know that

U^M ⊨ ∀x∃y(Older(y, x) → Admires(x, y))[g_∅]

if and only if

for all elements d of D, U^M ⊨∃y(Older(y, x) → Admires(x, y))[g_∅, d/x].

This is true. For each element d and assignment [g_∅, d/x], U^M ⊨ (Older(y, x) → Admires(x, y))[g_∅, d/x, d’/y], that is, there is some element d’ and variable assignment g differing from [g_∅, d/x] only in assigning d’ to ‘y’, such that g satisfies ‘(Older(y, x) → Admires(x, y))’ in U^M .

d. Model-theoretic consequence defined

For any set K of M-sentences and M-sentence X, we write

K ⊨ X

to mean that every M-structure that is a model of K is also a model of X, that is, X is a model-theoretic consequence of K.

(1) OlderThan(paige, matt)
(2) ∀x(Male(x) → OlderThan(paige, x))

Note that both (1) and (2) are false in the intended structure U^M . We show that (2) is not a model theoretic consequence of (1) by describing a structure which is a model of (1) but not (2). The above structure U’ will do the trick. By (I) it is true that U’ ⊨ OlderThan(paige, matt)[g_∅] because <(paige)[g_∅], (matt)[g_∅]> is in I_U’(OlderThan) (because 11 is greater than 3). But, by (VII), it is not the case that

U’ ⊨ ∀x(Male(x) → OlderThan(paige, x))[g_∅]

since the variable assignment [g_∅, 13/x] doesn’t satisfy ‘(Male(x) → OlderThan(paige, x))’ in U’ according to (V) for U’ ⊨ Male(x)[g_∅, 13/x] but not U’ ⊨ OlderThan(paige, x))[g_∅, 13/x]. So, (2) is not a model-theoretic consequence of (1). Consider the following sentences.

(3) (Admires(evan, paige) → Admires(paige, kelly))
(4) (Admires(paige, kelly) → Admires(kelly, beth))
(5) (Admires(evan, paige) → Admires(kelly, beth))

(5) is a model-theoretic consequence of (3) and (4). For assume otherwise. That is assume, that there is a structure U” such that

(i) U” ⊨ (Admires(evan, paige) → Admires(paige, kelly))[g_∅]

and

(ii) U” ⊨ (Admires(paige, kelly) → Admires(kelly, beth))[g_∅]

but not

(iii) U” ⊨ (Admires(evan, paige) → Admires(kelly, beth))[g_∅].

By (V), from the assumption that (iii) is false, it follows that U” ⊨ Admires(evan, paige)[g_∅] and not U” ⊨ Admires(kelly, beth)[g_∅]. Given the former, in order for (i) to hold according to (V) it must be the case that U” ⊨ Admires(paige, kelly))[g_∅]. But then it is true that U” ⊨ Admires(paige, kelly))[g_∅] and false that U” ⊨ Admires(kelly, beth)[g_∅], which, again appealing to (V), contradicts our assumption (ii). Hence, there is no such U”, and so (5) is a model-theoretic consequence of (3) and (4).

Here are some more examples of the model-theoretic consequence relation in action.

(6) ∃xMale(x)
(7) ∃xBrother(x, shannon)
(8) ∃x(Male(x) & Brother(x, shannon))

(8) is not a model-theoretic consequence of (6) and (7). Consider the following structure U”’.

D = {1, 2, 3}

For all M-individual constants c, I_U”’(c) = 1.

I_U”’(Male) = {2}, I_U”’(Brother) = {<3, 1>}. For all other M-predicates P, I_U”’(P) = ∅.

Appealing to the satisfaction clauses (I), (III), and (VI), it is fairly straightforward to see that the structure U”’ is a model of (6) and (7) but not of (8). For example, U”’ is not a model of (8) for there is no element d of D and assignment [d/x] such that

U”’ ⊨ (Male(x) & Brother(x, shannon))[g_∅, d/x].

Consider the following two sentences

(9) Female(shannon)
(10) ∃x Female(x)

(10) is a model-theoretic consequence of (9). For an arbitrary M-structure U, if U ⊨ Female(shannon)[g_∅], then by satisfaction clause (I), shannon[g_∅] is in I_U(Female), and so there is at least one element of D, shannon[g_∅], in I_U(Female). Consequently, by (VI), U ⊨∃x Female(x)[g_∅].

For a sentence X of M, we write

⊨ X.

to mean that X is a model-theoretic consequence of the empty set of sentences. This means that every M-structure is a model of X. Such sentences represent logical truths; it is not logically possible for them to be false. For example,

⊨ (∀x Male(x) → ∃x Male(x))

is true. Here’s one explanation why. Let U be an arbitrary M-structure. We now show that

U ⊨ (∀x Male(x) → ∃x Male(x))[g_∅].

If U ⊨ ∀x Male(x) [g_∅] holds, then by (VII) for every element d of the domain D, U ⊨ Male(x)[g_∅, d/x]. But we know that D is non-empty, by the requirements on structures (see the beginning of Section 4.1), and so D has at least one element d. Hence for at least one element d of D, U ⊨ Male(x)[g_∅, d/x], that is by (VI), U ⊨∃x Male(x))[g_∅]. So, if U ⊨ (∀x Male(x)[g_∅] then U ⊨∃x Male(x))[g_∅], and, therefore according to (V),

U ⊨ (∀x Male(x) → ∃x Male(x))[g_∅].

Since U is arbitrary, this establishes

⊨ (∀x Male(x) → ∃x Male(x)).

If we treat ‘=’ as a logical constant and require that for all M-structures U, I_U(=) = {<d, d’> ∈ D²| d = d’}, then M-sentences asserting that identity is reflexive, symmetrical, and transitive are true in every M-structure, that is the following hold.

⊨ ∀x(x = x)
⊨ ∀x∀y((x = y) → (y = x))
⊨ ∀x∀y∀z(((x = y) & (y = z)) → (x = z))

Structures which assign {<d, d’> ∈ D²| d = d’} to the identity symbol are sometimes called normal models. Letting Ψ(v) be any wff in which just variable v occurs free,

∀x∀y((x = y) → (Ψ(x) → Ψ(y)))

is an instance of the principle that identicals are indiscernible—if x = y then whatever holds of x holds of y—and it is true in every M-structure U that is a normal model. Treating ‘=’ as a logical constant (which is standard) requires that we restrict the class of M-structures appealed to in the above model-theoretic definition of logical consequence to those that are normal models.

5. The Status of the Model-Theoretic Characterization of Logical Consequence

Logical consequence in language M has been defined in terms of the model-theoretic consequence relation. What is the status of this definition? We answered this question in part in Logical Consequence, Deductive-Theoretic Conceptions: Section 5a. by highlighting Tarski’s argument for holding that the model-theoretic conception of logical consequence is more basic than any deductive-system account of it. Tarski points to the fact that there are languages for which valid principles of inference can’t be represented in a deductive-system, but the logical consequence relation they determine can be represented model-theoretically. In what follows, we identify the type of definition the model-theoretic characterization of logical consequence is, and then discuss its adequacy.

a. The model-theoretic characterization is a theoretical definition of logical consequence

In order to determine the success of the model-theoretic characterization, we need to know what type of definition it is. Clearly it is not intended as a lexical definition. As Tarski’s opening passage in his (1936) makes clear, a theory of logical consequence need not yield a report of what ‘logical consequence’ means. On other hand, it is clear that Tarski doesn’t see himself as offering just a stipulative definition. Tarski is not merely stating how he proposes to use ‘logical consequence’ and ‘logical truth’ (but see Tarski 1986) any more than Newton was just proposing how to use certain words when he defined force in terms of mass and acceleration. Newton was invoking a fundamental conceptual relationship in order to improve our understanding of the physical world. Similarly, Tarski’s definition of ‘logical consequence’ in terms of model-theoretic consequence is supposed to help us formulate a theory of logical consequence that deepens our understanding of what Tarski calls the common concept of logical consequence. Tarski thinks that the logical consequence relation is commonly regarded as necessary, formal, and a priori . As Tarski (1936, p. 409) says, “The concept of logical consequence is one of those whose introduction into a field of strict formal investigation was not a matter of arbitrary decision on the part of this or that investigator; in defining this concept efforts were made to adhere to the common usage of the language of everyday life.”

Let’s follow this approach in Tarski’s (1936) and treat the model-theoretic definition as a theoretical definition of ‘logical consequence’. The questions raised are whether the Tarskian model-theoretic definition of logical consequence leads to a good theory and whether it improves our understanding of logical consequence. In order to sketch a framework for thinking about this question, we review the key moves in the Tarskian analysis. In what follows, K is an arbitrary set of sentences from a language L, and X is any sentence from L. First, Tarski observes what he takes to be the commonly regarded features of logical consequence (necessity, formality, and a prioricity) and makes the following claim.

(1) X is a logical consequence of K if and only if (a) it is not possible for all the K to be true and X false, (b) this is due to the forms of the sentences, and (c) this is known a priori.

Tarski’s deep insight was to see the criteria, listed in bold, in terms of the technical notion of truth in a structure. The key step in his analysis is to embody the above criteria (a)-(c) in terms of the notion of a possible interpretation of the non-logical terminology in sentences. Substituting for what is in bold in (1) we get

(2) X is a logical consequence of K if and only if there is no possible interpretation of the non-logical terminology of the language according to which all the sentences in K are true and X is false.

The third step of the Tarskian analysis of logical consequence is to use the technical notion of truth in a structure or model to capture the idea of a possible interpretation. That is, we understand there is no possible interpretation of the non-logical terminology of the language according to which all of the sentences in K are true and X is false in terms of: Every model of K is a model of X, that is, K ⊨ X.

To elaborate, as reflected in (2), the analysis turns on a selection of terms as logical constants. This is represented model-theoretically by allowing the interpretation of the non-logical terminology to change from one structure to another, and by making the interpretation of the logical constants invariant across the class of structures. Then, relative to a set of terms treated as logical, the Tarskian, model-theoretic analysis is committed to

(3) X is a logical consequence of K if and only if K ⊨ X.

and

(4) X is a logical truth, that is, it is logically impossible for X to be false, if and only if ⊨ X.

As a theoretical definition, we expect the ⊨-relation to reflect the essential features of the common concept of logical consequence. By Tarski’s lights, the ⊨-consequence relation should be necessary, formal, and a priori. Note that model theory by itself does not provide the means for drawing a boundary between the logical and the non-logical. Indeed, its use presupposes that a list of logical terms is in hand. For example, taking Sister and Female to be logical constants, the consequence relation from (A) ‘Sister(kelly, paige)’ to (B) ‘Female(kelly)’ is necessary, formal and a priori. So perhaps (B) should be a logical consequence of (A). The fact that (B) is not a model-theoretic consequence of (A) is due to the fact that the interpretation of the two predicates can vary from one structure to another. To remedy this we could make the interpretation of the two predicates invariant so that ‘∀x(∃y Sister(x, y) → Female(x))’ is true in all structures, and, therefore if (A) is true in a structure, (B) is too. The point here is that the use of models to capture the logical consequence relation requires a prior choice of what terms to treat as logical. This is, in turn, reflected in the identification of the terms whose interpretation is constant from one structure to another.

So in assessing the success of the Tarskian model-theoretic definition of logical consequence for a language L, two issues arise. First, does the model-theoretic consequence relation reflect the salient features of the common concept of logical consequence? Second, is the boundary in L between logical and non-logical terms correctly drawn? In other words: what in L qualifies as a logical constant? Both questions are motivated by the adequacy criteria for theoretical definitions of logical consequence. They are central questions in the philosophy of logic and their significance is at least partly due to the prevalent use of model theory in logic to represent logical consequence in a variety of languages. In what follows, I sketch some responses to the two questions that draw on contemporary work in philosophy of logic. I begin with the first question.

b. Does the model-theoretic consequence relation reflect the salient features of the common concept of logical consequence?

The ⊨-consequence relation is formal. Also, a brief inspection of the above justifications that K ⊨ X obtain for given K and X reveals that the ⊨-consequence relation is a priori. Does the ⊨-consequence relation capture the modal element in the common concept of logical consequence? There are critics who argue that the model-theoretic account lacks the conceptual resources to rule out the possibility of there being logically possible situations in which sentences in K are true and X is false but no structure U such that U ⊨ K and not U ⊨ X. Kneale (1961) is an early critic, and Etchemendy (1988, 1999) offers a sustained and multi-faceted attack. We follow Etchemendy. Consider the following three sentences.

(1) (Female(shannon) & ~Married(shannon, matt))
(2) (~Female(matt) & Married(beth, matt))
(3) ~Female(beth)

(3) is neither a logical nor a model-theoretic consequence of (1) and (2). However, in order for a structure to make (1) and (2) true but not (3) its domain must have at least three elements. If the world contained, say, just two things, then there would be no such structure and (3) would be a model-theoretic consequence of (1) and (2). But in this scenario, (3) would not be a logical consequence of (1) and (2) because it would still be logically possible for the world to be larger and in such a possible situation (1) and (2) can be interpreted true and (3) false. The problem raised for the model-theoretic account of logical consequence is that we do not think that the class of logically possible situations varies under different assumptions as to the cardinality of the world’s elements. But the class of structures surely does since they are composed of worldly elements. This is a tricky criticism. Let’s look at it from a slightly different vantagepoint.

We might think that the extension of the logical consequence relation for an interpreted language such as our language M about the McKeons is necessary. For example, it can’t be the case that for some K and X, even though X isn’t a logical consequence of a set K of sentences, X could be. So, on the supposition that the world contains less, the extension of the logical consequence relation should not expand. However, the extension of the model-theoretic consequence does expand. For example, (3) is not, in fact, a model-theoretic consequence of (1) and (2), but it would be if there were just two things. This is evidence that the model-theoretic characterization has failed to capture the modal notion inherent in the common concept of logical consequence.

In defense of Tarski (see Ray 1999 and Sher 1991 for defenses of the Tarskian analysis against Etchemendy), one might question the force of the criticism because it rests on the supposition that it is possible for there to be just finitely many things. How could there be just two things? Indeed, if we countenance an infinite totality of necessary existents such as abstract objects (e.g., pure sets), then the class of structures will be fixed relative to an infinite collection of necessary existents, and the above criticism that turns on it being possible that there are just n things for finite n doesn’t go through (for discussion see McGee 1999). One could reply that while it is metaphysically impossible for there to be merely finitely many things it is nevertheless logically possible and this is relevant to the modal notion in the concept of logical consequence. This reply requires the existence of primitive, basic intuitions regarding the logical possibility of there being just finitely many things. However, intuitions about possible cardinalities of worldly individuals—not informed by mathematics and science—tend to run stale. Consequently, it is hard to debate this reply: one either has the needed logical intuitions, or not.

What is clear is that our knowledge of what is a model-theoretic consequence of what in a given L depends on our knowledge of the class of L-structures. Since such structures are furniture of the world, our knowledge of the model-theoretic consequence relation is grounded on knowledge of substantive facts about the world. Even if such knowledge is a priori, it is far from obvious that our a priori knowledge of the logical consequence relation is so substantive. One might argue that knowledge of what follows from what shouldn’t turn on worldly matters of fact, even if they are necessary and a priori (see the discussion of the locked room metaphor in Logical Consequence, Philosophical Considerations: Section 2.2.1). If correct, this is a strike against the model-theoretic definition. However, this standard logical positivist line has been recently challenged by those who see logic penetrated and permeated by metaphysics (e.g., Putnam 1971, Almog 1989, Sher 1991, Williamson 1999). We illustrate the insight behind the challenge with a simple example. Consider the following two sentences.

(4) ∃x(Female(x) & Sister(x, evan))
(5) ∃x Female(x)

(5) is a logical consequence of (4), that is, there is no domain for the quantifiers and no interpretation of the predicates and the individual constant in that domain which makes (4) true and not (5). Why? Because on any interpretation of the non-logical terminology, (4) is true just in case the intersection of the set of objects that satisfy Female(x) and the set of objects that satisfy Sister(x, evan) is non-empty. If this obtains, then the set of objects that satisfy Female(x) is non-empty and this makes (5) true. The basic metaphysical truth underlying the reasoning here is that for any two sets, if their intersection is non-empty, then neither set is the empty set. This necessary and a priori truth about the world, in particular about its set-theoretic part, is an essential reason why (5) follows from (4). This approach, reflected in the model-theoretic consequence relation (see Sher 1996), can lead to an intriguing view of the formality of logical consequence reminiscent of the pre-Wittgensteinian views of Russell and Frege. Following the above, the consequence relation from (4) to (5) is formal because the metaphysical truth on which it turns describes a formal (structural) feature of the world. In other words: it is not possible for (4) to be true and (5) false because

For any extensions of P, P’, if an object α satisfies (P(v) & P'(v, n)), then α satisfies P(v).

According to this vision of the formality of logical consequence, the consequence relation between (4) and (5) is formal because what is in bold expresses a formal feature of reality. Russell writes that, “Logic, I should maintain, must no more admit a unicorn than zoology can; for logic is concerned with the real world just as truly as zoology, though with its more abstract and general features” (Russell 1919, p. 169). If we take the abstract and general features of the world to be its formal features, then Russell’s remark captures the view of logic that emerges from anchoring the necessity, formality and a priority of logical consequence in the formal features of the world. The question arises as to what counts as a formal feature of the world. If we say that all set-theoretic truths depict formal features of the world, including claims about how many sets there are, then this would seem to justify making

∃x∃y~(x = y)

(that is, there are at least two individuals) a logical truth since it is necessary, a priori, and a formal truth. To reflect model-theoretically that such sentences, which consist just of logical terminology, are logical truths we would require that the domain of a structure simply be the collection of the world’s individuals. See Sher (1991) for an elaboration and defense of this view of the formality of logical truth and consequence. See Shapiro (1993) for further discussion and criticism of the project of grounding our logical knowledge on primitive intuitions of logical possibility instead of on our knowledge of metaphysical truths.

Part of the difficulty in reaching a consensus with respect to whether or not the model-theoretic consequence relation reflects the salient features of the common concept of logical consequence is that philosophers and logicians differ over what the features of the common concept are. Some offer accounts of the logical consequence relation according to which it is not a priori (e.g., see Koslow 1999, Sher 1991 and see Hanson 1997 for criticism of Sher) or deny that it even need be strongly necessary (Smiley 1995, 2000, section 6). Here we illustrate with a quick example.

Given that we know that a McKeon only admires those who are older (that is, we know that (a) ∀x∀y(Admires(x, y) → OlderThan(y, x))), wouldn’t we take (7) to be a logical consequences of (6)?

(6) Admires(paige, kelly)
(7) OlderThan(kelly, paige)

A Tarskian response is that (7) is not a consequence of (6) alone, but of (6) plus (a). So in thinking that (7) follows from (6), one assumes (a). A counter suggestion is to say that (7) is a logical consequence of (6) for if (6) is true, then necessarily-relative-to-the-truth-of-(a) (7) is true. The modal notion here is a weakened sense of necessity: necessity relative to the truth of a collection of sentences, which in this case is composed of (a). Since (a) is not a priori, neither is the consequence relation between (6) and (7). The motive here seems to be that this conception of modality is inherent in the notion of logical consequence that drives deductive inference in science, law, and other fields outside of the logic classroom. This supposes that a theory of logical consequence must not only account for the features of the intuitive concept of logical consequence but also reflect the intuitively correct deductive inferences. After all, the logical consequence relation is the foundation of deductive inference: it is not correct to deductively infer B from A unless B is a logical consequence of A. Referring to our example, in a conversation where (a) is a truth that is understood and accepted by the conversants, the inference from (6) to (7) seems legit. Hence, this should be supported by an accompanying concept of logical consequence. This idea of construing the common concept of logical consequence in part by the lights of basic intuitions about correct inferences is reflected in the Relevance logician’s objection to the Tarskian account. The Relevance logician claims that X is not a logical consequence of K unless K is relevant to X. For example, consider the following pairs of sentences.

(1) (Female(evan) & ~Female(evan)) (1) Admires(kelly, paige)

(2) Admires(kelly, shannon) (2) (Female(evan) v ~Female(evan))

In the first pair, (1) is logically false, and in the second, (2) is a logical truth. Hence it isn’t possible for (1) to be true and (2) false. Since this seems to be formally determined and a priori, for each pair (2) is a logical consequence of (1) according to Tarski. Against this Anderson and Belnap write, “the fancy that relevance is irrelevant to validity [that is logical consequence] strikes us as ludicrous, and we therefore make an attempt to explicate the notion of relevance of A to B” (Anderson and Belnap 1975, pp. 17-18). The typical support for the relevance conception of logical consequence draws on intuitions regarding correct inference, e.g. it is counterintuitive to think that it is correct to infer (2) from (1) in either pair for what does being a female have to do with who one admires? Would you think it correct to infer, say, that Admires(kelly, shannon) on the basis of (Female(evan) & ~Female(evan))? For further discussion of the different types of relevance logic and more on the relevant philosophical issues see Haack (1978, pp. 198-203) and Read (1995, pp. 54-63). The bibliography in Haack (1996, pp. 264-265) is helpful. For further discussion on relevance logic, see Logical Consequence, Deductive-Theoretic Conceptions: Section 5.2.1.

Our question is, does the model-theoretic consequence relation reflect the essential features of the common concept of logical consequence? Our discussion illustrates at least two things. First, it isn’t obvious that the model-theoretic definition of logical consequence reflects the Tarskian portrayal of the common concept. One option, not discussed above, is to deny that the model-theoretic definition is a theoretical definition and argue for its utility simply on the basis that it is extensionally equivalent with the common concept (see Shapiro 1998). Our discussion also illustrates that Tarski’s identification of the essential features of logical consequence is disputed. One reaction, not discussed above, is to question the presupposition of the debate and take a more pluralist approach to the common concept of logical consequence. On this line, it is not so much that the common concept of logical consequence is vague as it is ambiguous. At minimum, to say that a sentence X is a logical consequence of a set K of sentences is to say that X is true in every circumstance (that is logically possible situation) in which the sentences in K are true. “Different disambiguations of this notion arise from taking different extensions of the term ‘circumstance’ ” (Restall 2002, p. 427). If we disambiguate the relevant notion of ‘circumstance’ by the lights of Tarski, ‘Admires(kelly, paige)’ is a logical consequence of ‘(Female(evan) & ~Female(evan))’. If we follow the Relevance logician, then not. There is no fact of the matter about whether or not the first sentence is a logical consequence of the second independent of such a disambiguation.

c. What is a logical constant?

We turn to the second, related issue of what qualifies as a logical constant. Tarski (1936, 418-419) writes,

No objective grounds are known to me which permit us to draw a sharp boundary between [logical and non-logical terms]. It seems possible to include among logical terms some which are usually regarded by logicians as extra-logical without running into consequences which stand in sharp contrast to ordinary usage.

And at the end of his (1936), he tells us that the fluctuation in the common usage of the concept of consequence would be accurately reflected in a relative concept of logical consequence, that is a relative concept “which must, on each occasion, be related to a definite, although in greater or less degree arbitrary, division of terms into logical and extra logical” (p. 420). Unlike the relativity described in the previous paragraph, which speaks to the features of the concept of logical consequence, the relativity contemplated by Tarski concerns the selection of logical constants. Tarski’s observations of the common concept do not yield a sharp boundary between logical and non-logical terms. It seems that the sentential connectives and the quantifiers of our language M about the McKeons qualify as logical if any terms of M do. We’ve also followed many logicians and included the identity predicate as logical. (See Quine 1986 for considerations against treating ‘=’ as a logical constant.) But why not include other predicates such as ‘OlderThan’?

(1) OlderThan(kelly, paige) (3) ~OlderThan(kelly, kelly)
(2) ~OlderThan(paige, kelly)

Then the consequence relation from (1) to (2) is necessary, formal, and a priori and the truth of (3) is necessary, formal and also a priori. If treating ‘OlderThan’ as a logical constant does not do violence to our intuitions about the features of the common concept of logical consequence and truth, then it is hard to see why we should forbid such a treatment. By the lights of the relative concept of logical consequence, there is no fact of the matter about whether (2) is a logical consequence of (1) since it is relative to the selection of ‘OlderThan’ as a logical constant. On the other hand, Tarski hints that even by the lights of the relative concept there is something wrong in thinking that B follows from A and B only relative to taking ‘and’ as a logical constant. Rather, B follows from A and B we might say absolutely since ‘and’ should be on everybody’s list of logical constants. But why do ‘and’ and the other sentential connectives, along with the identity predicate and the quantifiers have more of a claim to logical constancy than, say, ‘OlderThan’? Tarski (1936) offers no criteria of logical constancy that help answer this question.

On the contemporary scene, there are three general approaches to the issue of what qualifies as a logical constant. One approach is to argue for an inherent property (or properties) of logical constancy that some expressions have and others lack. For example, topic neutrality is one feature traditionally thought to essentially characterize logical constants. The sentential connectives, the identity predicate, and the quantifiers seem topic neutral: they seem applicable to discourse on any topic. The predicates other than identity such as ‘OlderThan’ do not appear to be topic neutral, at least as standardly interpreted, e.g., ‘OlderThan’ has no application in the domain of natural numbers. One way of making the concept of topic neutrality precise is to follow Tarski’s suggestion in his (1986) that the logical notions expressed in a language L are those notions that are invariant under all one-one transformations of the domain of discourse onto itself. A one-one transformation of the domain of discourse onto itself is a one-one function whose domain and range coincide with the domain of discourse. And a one-one function is a function that always assigns different values to different objects in its domain (that is, for all x and y in the domain of f, if f(x) = f(y), then x = y).

Consider ‘Olderthan’. By Tarski’s lights, the notion expressed by the predicate is its extension, that is the set of ordered pairs <d, d’> such that d is older than d’. Recall that the extension is:

{<Beth, Matt>, <Beth, Shannon>, <Beth, Kelly>, <Beth, Paige>, <Beth, Evan>, <Matt, Shannon>, <Matt, Kelly>, <Matt, Paige>, <Matt, Evan>, <Shannon, Kelly>, <Shannon, Paige>, <Shannon, Evan>, <Kelly, Paige>, <Kelly, Evan>, <Paige, Evan>}.

If ‘OlderThan’ is a logical constant its extension (the notion it expresses) should be invariant under every one-one transformation of the domain of discourse (that is the set of McKeons) onto itself. A set is invariant under a one-one transformation f when the set is carried onto itself by the transformation. For example, the extension of ‘Female’ is invariant under f when for every d, d is a female if and only if f(d) is. ‘OlderThan’ is invariant under f when <d, d’> is in the extension of ‘OlderThan’ if and only if <f(d), f(d’)> is. Clearly, the extensions of the Female predicate and the Olderthan relation are not invariant under every one-one transformation. For example, Beth is older than Matt, but f(Beth) is not older than f(Matt) when f(Beth) = Evan and f(Matt) = Paige. Compare the identity relation: it is invariant under every one-one transformation of the domain of McKeons because it holds for each and every McKeon. The invariance condition makes precise the concept of topic neutrality. Any expression whose extension is altered by a one-one transformation must discriminate among elements of the domain, making the relevant notions topic-specific. The invariance condition can be extended in a straightforward way to the quantifiers and sentential connectives (see McCarthy 1981 and McGee 1997). Here I illustrate with the existential quantifier. Let Ψ be a well-formed formula with ‘x’ as its only free variable. ∃x Ψ has a truth-value in the intended structure U^M for our language M about the McKeons. Let f be an arbitrary one-one transformation of the domain D of McKeons onto itself. The function f determines an interpretation I’ for Ψ in the range D’ of f. The existential quantifier satisfies the invariance requirement for U^M ⊨∃x Ψ if and only if U ⊨∃x Ψ for every U derived by a one-one transformation f of the domain D of U^M (we say that the U‘s are isomorphic with U^M ).

For example, consider the following existential quantification.

∃x Female(x)

This is true in the intended structure for our language M about the McKeons (that is, U^M ⊨∃x Female(x)[g_∅]) ultimately because the set of elements that satisfy ‘Female(x)’ on some variable assignment that extends g_∅ is non-empty (recall that Beth, Shannon, Kelly, and Paige are females). The cardinality of the set of McKeons that satisfy an M-formula is invariant under every one-one transformation of the domain of McKeons onto itself. Hence, for every U isomorphic with U^M, the set of elements from D^U that satisfy ‘Female(x)’ on some variable assignment that extends g_∅ is non-empty and so

U ⊨∃x Female(x)[g_∅].

Speaking to the other part of the invariance requirement given at the end of the previous paragraph, clearly for every U isomorphic with U^M, if U ⊨∃x Female(x)[g_∅], then U^M ⊨∃x Female(x)[g_∅] (since U is isomorphic with itself). Crudely, the topic neutrality of the existential quantifier is confirmed by the fact that it is invariant under all one-one transformations of the domain of discourse onto itself.

Key here is that the cardinality of the subset of the domain D that satisfies an L-formula under an interpretation is invariant under every one-one transformation of D onto itself. For example, if at least two elements from D satisfy a formula on an interpretation of it, then at least two elements from D’ satisfy the formula under the I’ induced by f. This makes not only ‘All’ and ‘Some’ topic neutral, but also any cardinality quantifier such as ‘Most’, ‘Finitely many’, ‘Few’, ‘At least two’, etc. The view suggested in Tarski (1986, p. 149) is that the logic of a language L is the science of all notions expressible in L which are invariant under one-one transformations of L’s domain of discourse. For further discussion, defense of, and extensions of the Tarskian invariance requirement on logical constancy, in addition to McCarthy (1981) and McGee (1997), see Sher (1989, 1991).

A second approach to what qualifies as a logical constant is not to make topic neutrality a necessary condition for logical constancy. This undercuts at least some of the significance of the invariance requirement. Instead of thinking that there is an inherent property of logical constancy, we allow the choice of logical constants to depend, at least in part, on the needs at hand, as long as the resulting consequence relation reflects the essential features of the intuitive, pre-theoretic concept of logical consequence. I take this view to be very close to the one that we are left with by default in Tarski (1936). The approach is suggested in Prior (1976) and developed in related but different ways in Hanson (1996) and Warmbrod (1999). It amounts to regarding logic in a strict sense and loose sense. Logic in the strict sense is the science of what follows from what relative to topic neutral expressions, and logic in the loose sense is the study of what follows from what relative to both topic neutral expressions and those topic centered expressions of interest that yield a consequence relation possessing the salient features of the common concept.

Finally, a third approach the issue of what makes an expression a logical constant is simply to reject the view of logical consequence as a formal consequence relation, thereby nullifying the need to distinguish logical terminology in the first place (see Etchemendy 1983 and Bencivenga 1999). We just say, for example, that X is a logical consequence of a set K of sentences if the supposition that all of the K are true and X false violates the meaning of component terminology. Hence, ‘Female(kelly)’ is a logical consequence of ‘Sister(kelly, paige)’ simply because the supposition otherwise violates the meaning of the predicates. Whether or not ‘Female’ and ‘Sister’ are logical terms doesn’t come into play.

6. Conclusion

Using the first-order language M as the context for our inquiry, we have discussed the model-theoretic conception of the conditions that must be met in order for a sentence to be a logical consequence of others. This theoretical characterization is motivated by a distinct development of the common concept of logical consequence. The issue of the nature of logical consequence, which intersects with other areas of philosophy, is still a matter of debate. Any full coverage of the topic would involve study of the logical consequence relation between sentences from other types of languages such as modal languages (containing necessity and possibility operators) (see Hughes and Cresswell 1996) and second-order languages (containing variables that range over properties) (see Shapiro 1991). See also the entries, Logical Consequence, Philosophical Considerations, and Logical Consequence, Deductive-Theoretic Conceptions, in the encyclopedia.

7. References and Further Reading

Almog, J. (1989): “Logic and the World”, pp. 43-65 in Themes From Kaplan, ed. J. Almog, J. Perry, and H. Wettstein. New York: Oxford University Press.
Anderson, A.R., and N. Belnap (1975): Entailment: The Logic of Relevance and Necessity. Princeton: Princeton University Press.
Bencivenga, E. (1999): “What is Logic About?”, pp. 5-19 in Varzi (1999).
Etchemendy, J. (1983): “The Doctrine of Logic as Form”, Linguistics and Philosophy 6, pp. 319-334.
Etchemendy, J. (1988): “Tarski on truth and logical consequence”, Journal of Symbolic Logic 53, pp. 51-79.
Etchemendy, J. (1999): The Concept of Logical Consequence. Stanford: CSLI Publications.
Haack, S. (1978): Philosophy of Logics. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Haack, S. (1996): Deviant Logic, Fuzzy Logic. Chicago: The University of Chicago Press.
Hanson, W. (1997): “The Concept of Logical Consequence”, The Philosophical Review 106, pp. 365-409.
Hughes, G. E. and M.J Cresswell (1996): A New Introduction to Modal Logic. London: Routledge.
Kneale, W. (1961): “Universality and Necessity”, British Journal for the Philosophy of Science 12, pp. 89-102.
Kneale, W. and M. Kneale (1986): The Development of Logic. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
Koslow, A. (1999): “The Implicational Nature of Logic: A Structuralist Account”, pp. 111-155 in Varzi (1999).
McCarthy, T. (1981): “The Idea of a Logical Constant”, Journal of Philosophy 78, pp. 499-523.
McCarthy, T. (1998): “Logical Constants”, pp. 599-603 in Routledge Encyclopedia of Philosophy, vol. 5, ed. E. Craig. London: Routledge.
McGee, V. (1999): “Two Problems with Tarski’s Theory of Consequence”, Proceedings of the Aristotelean Society 92, pp. 273-292.
Priest. G. (1995): “Etchemendy and Logical Consequence”, Canadian Journal of Philosophy 25, pp. 283-292.
Prior, A. (1976): “What is Logic?”, pp. 122-129 in Papers in Logic and Ethics ed. P.T. Geach and A. Kenny. Amherst: University of Massachusetts Press.
Putnam, H. (1971): Philosophy of Logic. New York: Harper & Row.
Quine, W.V. (1986): Philosophy of Logic, 2nd ed. Cambridge: Harvard University Press.
Ray, G. (1996): “Logical Consequence: A Defense of Tarski”, Journal of Philosophical Logic 25, pp. 617-677.
Read, S. (1995): Thinking About Logic. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Restall, G. (2002): “Carnap’s Tolerance, Meaning, And Logical Pluralism”, Journal of Philosophy 99, pp. 426-443.
Russell, B. (1919): Introduction to Mathematical Philosophy. London: Routledge, 1993 printing.
Shapiro, S. (1991): Foundations without Foundationalism: A Case For Second-order Logic. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
Shapiro, S. (1993): “Modality and Ontology”, Mind 102, pp. 455-481.
Shapiro, S. (1998): “Logical Consequence: “Models and Modality”, pp. 131-156 in The Philosophy of Mathematics Today, ed. Matthias Schirn. Oxford, Clarendon Press.
Sher, G. (1989): “A Conception of Tarskian Logic”, Pacific Philosophical Quarterly 70, pp. 341-368.
Sher, G. (1991): The Bounds of Logic: A Generalized Viewpoint. Cambridge, Mass: MIT Press.
Sher, G. (1996): “Did Tarski Commit ‘Tarski’s Fallacy’?” Journal of Symbolic Logic 61, pp. 653-686.
Sher, G. (1999): “Is Logic a Theory of the Obvious?”, pp.207-238 in Varzi (1999).
Smiley, T. (1995): “A Tale of Two Tortoises”, Mind 104, pp. 725-36.
Smiley, T. (1998): “Consequence, Conceptions of”, pp. 599-603 in Routledge Encyclopedia of Philosophy, vol. 2, ed. E. Craig. London: Routledge.
Tarski, A. (1933): “Pojecie prawdy w jezykach nauk dedukeycyjnych”, translated as “On the Concept of Truth in Formalized Languages”, pp. 152-278 in Tarski (1983).
Tarski, A. (1936): “On the Concept of Logical Consequence”, pp. 409-420 in Tarski (1983).
Tarski, A. (1983): Logic, Semantics, Metamathematics 2nd ed. Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing.
Tarski, A. (1986): “What are Logical Notions?” History and Philosophy of Logic 7, pp. 143-154.
Varzi, A., ed. (1999): European Review of Philosophy, vol. 4, The Nature of Logic. Stanford: CSLI Publications.
Warbrod, K., (1999): “Logical Constants”, Mind 108, pp. 503-538.

Author Information

Matthew McKeon
Email: mckeonm@msu.edu
Michigan State University
U. S. A.

James Beattie (1735—1803)

beattie James Beattie was a Scottish philosopher and poet who spent his entire academic career as Professor of Moral Philosophy and Logic at Marischal College in Aberdeen. His best known philosophical work, An Essay on The Nature and Immutability of Truth In Opposition to Sophistry and Scepticism (1770), is a rhetorical tour de force which affirmed the sovereignty of common sense while attacking David Hume (1711-1776). A smash bestseller in its day, this Essay on Truth made Beattie very famous and Hume very angry. The work’s fame proved fleeting, as did Beattie’s philosophical reputation.

While the Essay on Truth is little read today, it is well worth reading. First, it is an important document in the history of the Scottish common sense school of philosophy inaugurated by Beattie’s colleague, Thomas Reid (1710-1796). Second, Beattie’s style– lively, polished, pure, and lucid–still has the power to please and charm. Finally, Beattie is an abler philosopher than his vociferous detractors were willing to allow. Though by no means an original or profound thinker, he can and should be given credit for presenting a systematic and accessible defense of a simple-sounding thesis – that philosophy cannot afford to despise the plain dictates of common sense.

This article (1) outlines Beattie’s life and career, (2) reviews the basic argument of the Essay on Truth, (3) summarizes the Essay‘s neglected critique of Hume’s racism, (4) briefly describes Beattie’s later Elements of Moral Science, and (5) reflects on Beattie’s place in the Scottish common sense school.

Life and Career
The Essay on Truth (1770)
Beattie Contra Hume on Racism
Elements of Moral Science (1790-1793)
Beattie and Scottish Common Sense Philosophy
References and Further Reading

1. Life and Career

James Beattie was born October 25, 1735 in Laurencekirk, Kincardineshire, where his father was a farmer and shopkeeper. In 1749 Beattie began his studies at Marischal College, Aberdeen. In 1753, he was awarded the MA degree. He then spent several years as a schoolteacher and briefly contemplated becoming a minister. During this period he also secured the friendship of several influential personages. One of Beattie’s early patrons was James Burnett (1714-1799), better known to posterity as Lord Monboddo (which name Burnett assumed when appointed to the Court of Session in 1767).

In 1760, at the tender age of 25, Beattie was installed as Professor of Moral Philosophy and Logic at Marischal College. Shortly thereafter he was elected to the Aberdeen Philosophical Society, known to waggish locals as “the Wise Club.” Founded in 1758 by Thomas Reid (1710-1796) and John Gregory (1724-1773), the Society continued to hold meetings until 1773, nine years after Reid left for Glasgow to fill the Chair of Moral Philosophy vacated by Adam Smith (1723-1790). Much of Beattie’s later work had its origin in compositions read to his fellow Aberdonian “wise men” in the 1760s.

A decade after taking up his Professorship at Aberdeen, Beattie published the philosophical work for which he was (and is still) best known: An Essay on the Nature and Immutability of Truth In Opposition to Sophistry and Scepticism (1770) (hereinafter “Essay on Truth”). The honors piled up thick and fast: a doctorate of laws from Oxford; an audience with King George III; a Crown pension of 200 pounds a year; the approbation of discerning literati such as Edmund Burke and Samuel Johnson; and the opportunity to pose for Sir Joshua Reynolds. (Incidentally, Reynold’s portrait of Beattie – “The Triumph of Truth, with the Portrait of a Gentleman”- was hung in Marischal College.) Nor was enthusiasm for Beattie’s anti-skeptical treatise confined to the British Isles. The Essay was soon translated into French, German, and Dutch and discussed on the Continent. Beattie’s fame spread to the New World as well. In 1784 he was made a member of the American Philosophical Society.

Not all citizens of the Republic of Letters, however, were impressed by the Essay on Truth. The book’s target, the amiable and good-humored Hume, was incensed. “Truth!” he fumed, “there is no truth in it; it is a horrible large lie in Octavo.” Yet Hume, who had a policy of not answering critics, never deigned to reply directly to the cavils of “that bigoted silly fellow Beattie.” Immanuel Kant (1724-1804), too, had harsh words for Beattie. In Kant’s Prolegomena to Any Future Metaphysics (1783), the Scottish prophet of common sense is portrayed as a superficial, obtuse dogmatist: “I should think that Hume might fairly have laid as much claim to common sense as Beattie, and in addition to a critical reason (such as the latter did not possess).” (For the record, however, it should be noted that Kant (unlike Hume) had an equally low opinion of Reid.)

Beattie wrote no philosophical work equal to the Essay in appeal or influence, although he continued to publish throughout the 1770s and 1780s. Many of these ostensibly “later” works (several of which actually date from the 1760s) are devoted to issues in aesthetics, rhetoric, and literary theory. They include An Essay on Poetry and Music (1776), On the Utility of Classical Learning (1776), An Essay on Laughter, and Ludicrous Composition (1779), and Dissertations Moral and Critical (1783). In addition, he compiled a lexicon entitled Scotticisms, arranged in Alphabetical Order (1787), in which he urged his educated compatriots to improve their English by “purifying” it of Scots expressions.

Beattie also earned plaudits as a poet, largely on the strength of The Minstrel; or, The Progress of Genius, written in Spenserian stanzas. The first part of The Minstrel appeared anonymously in 1771 (a year which also saw two editions of the Essay printed). The second part, to which the author put his name, followed in 1774. Replete with reflections upon Nature and the character of poetic genius, The Minstrel anticipates some of the central preoccupations of the Romantic movement.

Despite his apparent “aesthetic turn” in the post-Essay period, Beattie remained interested in the broader philosophical, moral, and religious questions that had originally prompted him to compose the Essay on Truth in the 1760s. 1786 saw the publication of Evidences of the Christian Religion Briefly and Plainly Stated, a two volume work of popular apologetics. This was followed by his final book, Elements of Moral Science (1790-1793). A lengthy collection of lectures delivered at Marischal College, the Elements deal with a wide range of topics in the philosophy of mind, epistemology, metaphysics, logic, ethics, political philosophy, economics, and natural theology.

Beattie’s later years were filled with affliction. His wife, Mary Beattie (née Dunn), went mad and was eventually committed to an asylum. Both of his children died, the elder son in 1790 and the younger in 1796. Weakened by grief, ill health, and a series of strokes, Beattie died in Aberdeen on August 18, 1803.

2. The Essay on Truth (1770)

The Essay on Truth begins predictably enough, with a definition of – what else?- truth. Truth, Beattie avows, is identified with what “the constitution of our nature determines us to believe”; falsehood is identified with what “the constitution of our nature determines us to disbelieve.” (Part I. i). The distinction between common sense and reason is drawn in terms of the way that distinct classes of truths are apprehended. Common sense is identified as “that faculty by which we perceive self-evident truth,” whereas reason is “that power by which we perceive truth in consequence of a proof.” (I. i). With these definitions securely in place, Beattie advances the Essay‘s principal thesis — “common sense is the ultimate judge of truth,” (I. i) and reason must be subordinated to it. All sound reasoning, we are told, depends upon the principles of common sense:

In a word, the dictates of common sense are, in respect to human knowledge in general, what the axioms of geometry are in respect to mathematics: on the supposition that those axioms are false or dubious, all mathematical reasoning falls to the ground; and on the supposition that the dictates of common sense are erroneous and deceitful, all science, truth, and virtue, are vain. (I. ii. 9)

What are these axioms of common sense, these foundational principles on which all sound reasoning rests? It is not necessary to discuss all the principles listed in Beattie’s catalogue of common sense. For the purpose of illustration, a representative sample of four “principles of common sense” should suffice: (i) the evidence of perception (or “external sense”) is not fallacious, but fundamentally reliable; (ii) whatever begins to exist, proceeds from some cause; (iii) Nature is uniform; and (iv) human testimony is basically trustworthy. Armed with this arsenal of principles, Beattie can now confidently enter the lists against an assortment of formidable philosophical foes. Beattie wielded principle (i) against skeptics (be they Cartesian or Humean), as well as against Berkeleyan idealists; principle (ii) against atheist critics of cosmological arguments; principle (iii) against Humean skeptics about induction; and principle (iv) against Humean scoffers at miracles.

If Beattie is right about common sense, much (if not all) of modern philosophy is wrong. The basic mistake of the moderns lies in their tendency to make reason, not common-sense, the ultimate judge or arbiter of truth. Reason is a shameless upstart who, ignorant of its proper station, disgraces itself by refusing to submit to authority (in the form of common sense). Such insubordination can only lead to chaos, catastrophe, and confusion:

When Reason invades the rights of Common Sense, and presumes to arraign that authority by which she herself acts, nonsense and confusion must of necessity ensue; science will soon come to have neither head nor tail, beginning nor end; philosophy will grow contemptible; and its adherents, far from being treated, as in former times, upon the footing of conjurers, will be thought by the vulgar, and by every man of sense, to be little better than downright fools. (I. ii. 9)

Philosophers therefore despise common sense at their peril. But how are we to distinguish genuine principles of common sense from the pretenders? Is Beattie suggesting that any cherished conviction or idée fixe that I am unable to prove automatically qualifies as a dictate of common sense? He endeavours to supply us with criteria or marks by which authentic principles of common sense can be identified. (1) We are irresistibly inclined by nature to believe the principles of common sense. Our powerful attachment to them, being spontaneous and quasi-instinctive, cannot be destroyed by philosophical argument – no matter how ingenious. (2) The principles of common sense are universally accepted. Far from being prejudices peculiar to a given time, place, culture, sect, or class, they have been believed by virtually all people in all ages. (3) The principles of common sense cannot be proven because they are epistemologically foundational or basic. They cannot be justified by reference to some more evident proposition(s), because none exist. (4) The principles of common sense are indispensable presuppositions of our conduct and practice. We cannot live or act prudently unless we assume that our senses are reliable, that human testimony can be a source of knowledge, that past will resemble the future, and so on. Anyone who actually doubted or denied such principles would put himself on par with the lunatic or the fool.

Here it may be asked: In what way does Beattie’s Essay on Truth improve upon Thomas Reid’s earlier Inquiry into the Human Mind on the Principles of Common Sense (1764)? The short answer is that it does not. Beattie freely admits that he is heavily indebted to Reid. However, the Essay differs from the Inquiry in one obvious respect: Beattie’s tract is infinitely more hard-hitting and caustic than anything ever penned by Reid. Where Reid writes respectfully of his opponents, Beattie tends to denounce and vilify them. Where Reid wraps up his subtle thoughts in restrained professorial prose, Beattie’s simple arguments are presented with the spleen and verve of the born orator. These contrasts reflect a more basic difference between our two defenders of common sense. Unlike Reid, Beattie is first and foremost a moralist and an apologist. He is not interested in defending a subtle or nuanced philosophical thesis. Rather, Beattie is defending a lofty (albeit vaguely defined) cause – to wit, “the cause of truth, virtue, and mankind.” Translated into more prosaic (but precise) terms, Beattie’s “cause” is that of deflecting philosophical opposition to a broadly Judeo-Christian understanding of human nature. According to this understanding, human beings are free but finite creatures made in the image of a good God or Creator. Neither brutes nor divinities, we occupy an intermediate place in creation and are better suited for action than for speculation. Inasmuch as our cognitive faculties are God-given, we may trust their deliverances – provided we acknowledge their limitations and exercise them under conditions that define our humble “middle state” (to quote Alexander Pope). Beattie’s bold strategy in the Essay was to argue that these familiar ideas about human nature are unassailable because they rest on the solid and irrefragable foundation of “common sense” (rather than philosophic demonstrability). Here was a book apt to reassure the devout but timorous Christian reader, for it confidently announced that Humean scepticism – and the bulk of modern philosophy – was infinitely more suited to be ridiculed than to be feared.

3. Beattie Contra Hume on Racism

Although the Essay on Truth is largely devoted to re-instating the rights of common sense in the spheres of epistemology and metaphysics, it includes a forceful critique of Hume’s racism.

Hume’s racism? To some, this phrase may have a strange and novel sound. After all, Hume is usually portrayed as a patron saint of the Enlightenment: a genial cosmopolitan, sweetly reasonable, unfailingly courteous and amiable, “as approaching as nearly to the idea of a perfectly wise and virtuous man, as perhaps the nature of human frailty will permit” (in the oft-cited words of his friend, Adam Smith). Yet in Hume’s essay “Of National Characters,” we catch a glimpse of a different side of le bon David. For there, in an infamous footnote, Hume writes:

I am apt to suspect the negroes to be naturally inferior to the whites. There scarcely ever was a civilized nation of that complexion, nor any individual, eminent either in action or speculation. No ingenious manufactures amongst them, no arts, no sciences … [T]here are Negroe slaves dispersed all over Europe, of whom none ever discovered any symptoms of ingenuity.

In the Essay on Truth, Beattie condemns these sentiments: “These assertions are strong; but I know not whether they have anything else to recommend them.” (III. ii). Beattie does not stop there. Beattie does not merely fulminate against Hume’s racism with a self-serving show of conspicuous indignation; instead he rolls up his sleeves and adroitly dissects Hume’s pro-racist arguments. (1) Beattie disputes Hume’s basic assertions about the achievements (or alleged lack thereof) of non-European societies: “[W]e know that these assertions are not true … The Africans and Americans are known to have many ingenious manufactures and arts among them, which even Europeans would find it no easy matter to imitate.” (III. ii). (2) Moreover, Beattie says, Hume’s reasoning is invalid. For even if Hume’s claims were correct, his conclusion would not follow. “[O]ne may as well say of an infant, that he can never become a man, as of a nation now barbarous, that it never can be civilized.” (III. Ii). Should anyone doubt this, he need only recall that “[t]hat the inhabitants of Great Britain and France were as savage two thousand years ago, as those of Africa and America are at this day.” (III. ii). (3) Beattie is unimpressed by Hume’s argument that “there are Negroe slaves dispersed all over Europe, of whom none ever discovered any symptoms of ingenuity.” Beattie insists that this claim is unwarranted as well as false. But even if it were true, it would not justify belief in Hume’s natural inferiority thesis, for “the condition of a slave is not favourable to genius of any kind.” (III. ii). (4) While Beattie does not downgrade European achievements in the arts and sciences, he denies that they can be used to prove that European nations or “races” are superior. He stresses the extent that the achievements on which European nations pride themselves were either discovered by accident or the inventions of a gifted few, to whom alone all credit must go.

Beattie caps his rebuttal with two observations. First, his critique of Hume’s natural inferiority thesis indirectly supports the cause of religion because such racism cannot be reconciled neatly with a true Judeo-Christian understanding of human nature. Second, Beattie stresses that his disagreement with Hume on the subject of racism is not merely theoretical or speculative. On the contrary, the dispute is intensely practical, for the natural inferiority thesis can (and frequently was) invoked to justify slavery – an institution that Beattie, a committed abolitionist, decried as “a barbarous piece of policy.”

4. Elements of Moral Science (1790-1793)

There is considerable overlap between the Essay on Truth and Beattie’s later Elements of Moral Science (1790-1793). The creed of common sense is again soberly recited. We are told that consciousness, memory, and testimony must be taken as trustworthy, that we can assume that Nature is uniform, that we are free moral agents, and that whatever begins to exist must proceed from some cause.

Despite these and other doctrinal similarities, the Elements differs from the Essay in at least four respects. First, stylistically the Essay was full of sarcasm, scorn and splendid invective, while the Elements is comparatively tame, subdued, and dry. Second, the Elements is more philosophically constructive than the Essay, as Beattie now appears more interested in building and inhabiting his own modest system than in laying siege to the systems of foes and rivals. Third, the Elements offers a more in-depth exploration of several topics only lightly touched upon in the Essay (for example, perception, natural theology, and immortality). Finally, the Elements offers sustained coverage of several areas, such as political philosophy and economics, that are not meaningfully discussed in the Essay.

5. Beattie and Scottish Common Sense Philosophy

Historians of Scottish philosophy frequently describe Beattie’s Essay as a simplified version of the philosophy of common sense expounded by Reid in his Inquiry of 1764. While there is much truth in this judgment, it need not be construed as a reproach. Popularization can be done well or badly. Beattie did it well.

Nevertheless, it is undeniable that Reid’s views on matters philosophical evolved in a way that Beattie’s never did. After retiring from teaching in 1781, Reid published two major works, Essays on the Intellectual Powers of Man (1785) and Essays on the Active Powers of Man (1788). More sophisticated and constructive than anything Beattie ever produced, these two books, along with Reid’s earlier Inquiry, became the founding documents of the Scottish common sense school of philosophy. The Reidian gospel was soon propagated with aplomb by Edinburgh Chair-holder Dugald Stewart (1753-1828), who had listened to Reid’s lectures in Glasgow. An elegant stylist, Stewart championed common sense both in his well-attended lectures and in his edifying books, the first pair of which – Elements of the Philosophy of the Human Mind (1792) and Outlines of Moral Philosophy (1793) – appeared around the same time as Beattie’s Elements of Moral Science. Stewart’s interest in Reid was shared by another renowned Edinburgh professor, the erudite but preternaturally verbose Sir William Hamilton (1788-1856). No slavish disciple, Hamilton sought to “improve” on Reid’s philosophy in various ways, often by drawing on Kantian doctrines. A singular philosophical beast, the resulting hybrid was slain, stuffed, and mounted by John Stuart Mill (1806-1873) in An Examination of Sir William Hamilton’s Philosophy (1865). Nevertheless, Hamilton’s extensively (or, as some might say, obsessively) annotated edition of Reid’s Collected Works did much to make them more widely available.

With Reid cast thus as the heroic founder of the emerging Scotch school, Beattie was relegated to the supporting role of ardent and skilful propagandist. This, at any rate, was how Dugald Stewart portrays Beattie in a letter to Sir William Forbes, Beattie’s friend and biographer. Stewart declares that the Essay on Truth is effective as “a popular antidote against the illusions of metaphysical scepticism,” but, he is quick to add, Beattie’s polemic lacks the subtlety, patience, and precision we find in Reid. Nevertheless, Stewart avers that Beattie’s achievement is not negligible:

These critical remarks on the “Essay on Truth” (I must request you to observe) do not in the least affect the essential merits of that very valuable performance; and I have stated them with the greater freedom, because your late excellent friend possessed so many other unquestionable claims to high distinction – as a moralist, as a critic, as a grammarian, as a pure and classical writer, and, above all, as the author of the “Minstrel.” In any one of the different paths to which his ambition has led him, it would not perhaps be difficult to name some of his contemporaries by whom he has been surpassed; but where is the individual to be found, who has aspired with greater success to an equal variety of literary honours?

Stewart’s verdict still seems a just one. Beattie was a talented, ambitious, and multi-faceted man of letters, but his gifts and merits as a philosopher were not the greatest. If philosophy is indeed “a series of footnotes to Plato” (Whitehead), then Beattie can be read as a dramatic footnote to Reid and – ironically – to the abhorred Hume.

6. References and Further Reading

Cloyd, E. L. (1972) James Burnett, Lord Monboddo. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
- Touches on Monboddo’s relationship with Beattie; indicates why their friendship did not last.
Fieser, J. (1994) “Beattie’s Lost Letter to the London Review,” Hume Studies 20: 1-12.
- Reconstructs a controversy between Beattie and a pro-Humean literary faction.
Fieser, J. (2000) “Introduction” to James Beattie’s Essay on the Nature and Immutability of Truth in Opposition to Sophistry and Scepticism. Volume 2 of the 5 volume set, Scottish Common Sense Philosophy: Sources and Origins. (ed. J. Fieser) Bristol, UK: Thoemmes Press.
- Thorough presentation of Beattie’s defence of common sense in the Essay on Truth.
Fieser, J. (ed.) (2000) Early Responses to Reid, Oswald, Beattie, and Stewart: I. Volume 3 of the 5 volume set, Scottish Common Sense Philosophy: Sources and Origins. Bristol, UK: Thoemmes Press.
- Contains early reviews of the Essay (including Edmund Burke’s positive notice of the second edition of 1771).
Grave, S.A. (1960) The Scottish Philosophy of Common Sense. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
- Beattie’s epistemological and metaphysical views are portrayed as vulgarized versions of Reid’s.
Harris, J. A. (2002) “James Beattie, The Doctrine of Liberty, and the Science of the Mind,” Reid Studies (5): 16-29.
- Acknowledges Beattie’s shortcomings as a philosopher, but credits him with a commitment to understanding the human mind scientifically. Sheds light on the Essay’s critique of necessitarianism.
King, E.H. (1971) “A Scottish “Philosophical” Club in the Eighteenth Century,” Dalhousie Review (50): 201-214.
- Describes the inner workings of the Aberdeen Philosophical Society, and discusses Beattie’s participation.
King, E.H. (1972) “James Beattie’s Essay on Truth (1770): An Enlightenment “Bestseller”,” Dalhousie Review (51): 390-403.
- An account of the Essay‘s popularity.
Kuehn, M. (1987) Scottish Common Sense in Germany, 1768-1800: A Contribution to the History of the Critical Philosophy. Kingston and Montreal: McGill-Queen’s University Press.
- Discusses the influence of Reid and, to a lesser extent, Beattie and Oswald upon Kant and his German contemporaries. A clear-headed, fair assessment of Beattie’s strengths and weaknesses.
McCosh, J. (1875) The Scottish Philosophy. London: Macmillan.
- Chapter XXIX contains a biographical sketch and an outline of the Essay. Depicts Beattie as an eloquent popularizer of the philosophy of common sense.
Mossner, E.C. (1980) The Life of David Hume. 2nd edition. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
- Briefly describes the reaction of Hume and his Edinburgh circle to the Essay‘s success.
Popkin, R.H. (1980) The High Road to Pyrrhonism. San Diego: Austin Hill Press.
- Contains an article entitled “Hume’s Racism” (pp. 251-266), in which Popkin helpfully puts Beattie’s critique of Hume’s racism in historical context.
Priestley, J. (1774) An Examination of Dr. Reid’s Inquiry into the Human Mind on the Principles of Common Sense, Dr. Beattie’s Essay on the Nature and Immutability of Truth, and Dr. Oswald’s Appeal to Common Sense in Behalf of Religion. London: J. Johnson.
- Includes an extended critique of Beattie, composed shortly after the Essay’s publication. Priestley complains that the Essay‘s author is (among other things) an incorrigible dogmatist who relies too heavily on ad hominem arguments. The Appendix includes some correspondence between Beattie and Priestley.

Author Information

Douglas McDermid
Email: dmcdermi@trentu.ca
Trent University
Canada

Epiphenomenalism

Epiphenomenalism is a position in the philosophy of mind according to which mental states or events are caused by physical states or events in the brain but do not themselves cause anything. It seems as if our mental life affects our body, and, via our body, the physical world surrounding us: it seems that sharp pains make us wince, it seems that fear makes our heart beat faster, it seems that remembering an embarrassing situation makes us blush and it seems that the perception of an old friend makes us smile. In reality, however, these sequences are the result of causal processes at an underlying physical level: what makes us wince is not the pain, but the neurophysiological process which causes the pain; what makes our heart beat faster is not fear, but the state of our nervous system which causes the fear etc. According to a famous analogy of Thomas Henry Huxley, the relationship between mind and brain is like the relationship between the steam-whistle which accompanies the work of a locomotive engine and the engine itself: just as the steam-whistle is caused by the engine’s operations but has no causal influence upon it, so too the mental is caused by the workings of neurophysiological mechanisms but has no causal influence upon their operation.

What Is Epiphenomenalism?
Epiphenomenalism in the 18th and 19th Century
Epiphenomenalism in the 20th Century
Arguments for Epiphenomenalism
Arguments against Epiphenomenalism
References and Further Reading

1. What Is Epiphenomenalism?

In the beginning epiphenomenalism was known as the doctrine of “automatism” or as the “conscious automaton theory.” The term “epiphenomenalism” seems to have been introduced in 1890 in William James’s The Principles of Psychology (it occurs once in the chapter entitled “The Automaton-Theory;” other than that James uses the terms “automaton-theory” or “conscious automaton-theory;” see Robinson 2003). The term “epiphenomenon” was used in medicine in the late nineteenth century as a label for a symptom concurrent with, but not causally contributory to, a disease (an epiphenomenon is thus something like a secondary symptom, a mere afterglow of real phenomena). Accordingly, epiphenomenalism in the philosophy of mind holds that our actions have purely physical causes (neurophysiological changes in the brain, say), while our intention, desire or volition to act does not cause our actions but is itself caused by the physical causes of our actions. To assume that regular successions of mental and physical events—volitions followed by appropriate behavior, fear followed by an increased heart rate, pains followed by wincings etc.—reflect causal processes is to commit the fallacy of post hoc, propter hoc: “The soul stands related to the body as the bell of a clock to the works, and consciousness answers to the sound which the bell gives out when it is struck” (Huxley 1874, 242).

2. Epiphenomenalism in the 18th and 19th Century

One of the first explicit formulations of epiphenomenalism can be found in the Essai de Psychologie of the Swiss naturalist and philosophical writer Charles Bonnet, dating from 1755: “the soul is a mere spectator of the movements of its body; […] the latter performs of itself all that series of actions which constitutes life; […] it moves of itself; […] it is the body alone which reproduces ideas, compares and arranges them; which forms reasonings, imagines and executes plans of all kinds, etc.” (Bonnet 1755, 91). More than a century later, the British philosopher Shadworth Hodgson also expressed the view that “[s]tates of consciousness are not produced by previous states of consciousness, but both are produced by the action of the brain; and, conversely, there is no ground for saying that […] states of consciousness react upon the brain or modify its action” (Hodgson 1865, part 1, ch. 5, §30). The most prominent articulation and defense of epiphenomenalism, however, stems from the Presidential Address to the British Association for the Advancement of Science of the British biologist, physiologist and philosopher Thomas Henry Huxley, published in 1874 with the suggestive title “On the hypothesis that animals are automata, and its history.” Huxley argued that brute animals and (presumably) human beings are conscious automata: they enjoy a conscious mental life, but their behavior is determined solely by physical mechanisms. Huxley was convinced that the body of humans and animals is a purely physical mechanism and that the physical processes of life are explainable in the same way as all other physical phenomena. This mechanistic conception, he held, “has not only successfully repelled every assault that has been made upon it, but […] is now the expressed or implied fundamental proposition of the whole doctrine of scientific Physiology” (Huxley 1874, 200). Already Descartes had argued that non-human animals are mere mechanical automata and subject to the same laws as other unconscious matter, and Huxley wholeheartedly embraced Descartes’s defense of automatism by appeal to reflex actions (Huxley 1874, 218). Huxley observed that a frog with certain parts of his brain extracted was unable to initiate actions but nevertheless able to carry out a range of reflex-like actions. Since he thought that the partial leucotomy made sure the frog was totally unconscious, he concluded that consciousness was not necessary for the execution of reflex actions:

The frog walks, hops, swims, and goes through his gymnastic performances quite as well without consciousness, and consequently without volition, as with it; and, if a frog, in his natural state, possesses anything corresponding with what we call volition, there is no reason to think that it is anything but a concomitant of the molecular changes in the brain which form part of the series involved in the production of motion. (Huxley 1874, 240)

Huxley agreed with Descartes that animals are automata, but he was unwilling to accept that they are devoid of mentality: “Sleeping dogs frequently appear to dream. If they do, it must be admitted that ideation goes on in them while they are asleep; and, in that case, there is no reason to doubt that they are conscious” (Huxley 1898, 125). Huxley therefore segregated the question of consciousness from the question of the status of an automaton: animals do experience pain, but that pain is, like their bodily movements, just a result of neurophysiological processes. Animals are conscious automata. In contrast to Descartes, Huxley argued that considerations similar to those about reflex actions in frogs also suggest that we are conscious automata. He referred to a case study of a certain Dr. Mesnet who had examined a French soldier who had suffered severe brain damage during the Franco-Prussian war in 1870. From time to time this soldier fell into a trance-like state in which he was able to execute a series of complex actions while apparently being unconscious:

If the man happens to be in a place to which he is accustomed, he walks about as usual; […] He eats, drinks, smokes, walks about, dresses and undresses himself, rises and goes to bed at the accustomed hours. Nevertheless, pins may be run into his body, or strong electric shocks sent through it, without causing the least indication of pain; no odorous substance, pleasant or unpleasant, makes the least impression; he eats and drinks with avidity whatever is offered, and takes asafœtida, or vinegar, or quinine, as readily as water; no noise affects him; and light influences him only under certain conditions. (Huxley 1874, 228)

Since Mesnet’s patient could carry out actions ordinarily performed with consciousness as initiating or coordinating element while apparently being unconscious, consciousness did not seem to be necessary for their execution. Since it was impossible to prove that the patient was indeed unconscious in his abnormal state, Huxley did not claim to have proven that humans are conscious automata, but he at least thought that “the case of the frog goes a long way to justify the assumption that, in the abnormal state, the man is a mere insensible machine” (Huxley 1874, 235). Huxley’s naturalistic or mechanistic attitude towards the body convinced him that the brain alone causes behavior. At the same time, his dualism convinced him that the mental is essentially non-physical. He reconciled these apparently discordant claims by degrading mentality to the status of an epiphenomenon.

3. Epiphenomenalism in the 20th Century

Most contemporary philosophers reject substance dualism and the question that plagued Descartes–How can an immaterial mind whose nature is to think and a material body whose nature is to be spatially extended causally interact?–no longer arises. Moreover, many philosophers even reject Huxley’s event-dualism in favor of psychophysical event-identities. According to one version of non-reductive physicalism, for instance, every concrete mental event (every event token) is identical to a concrete physical event, although there are no one-one correlations between mental and physical properties (event types). Since fear is identical to the neurophysiological event which causes the increased heart rate, fear causes the increased heart rate, too, and epiphenomenalism seems avoided. However, the charge of epiphenomenalism re-arises in a different guise. There is a forceful intuition that events cause what they cause in virtue of some of their properties. Suppose a soprano sings the word “freedom” at a high pitch and amplitude, causing a nearby window to shatter. The singing which causes the shattering is both the singing of a high C and the singing of the word “freedom.” Intuitively, only the former, not the latter, is causally relevant for the singing’s causing the shattering: “Meaningful sounds, if they occur at the right pitch and amplitude, can shatter glass, but the fact that the sounds have meaning is irrelevant to their effect. The glass would shatter if the sounds meant something completely different or if they meant nothing at all” (Dretske 1989, 1-2). If events cause their effects in virtue of some of their properties but not in virtue of others, the question arises whether mental events (even if they are identical to physical events) cause their effects in virtue of their mental, their physical or both kinds of properties. If mental events cause their effects only in virtue of their physical properties, then their being mental events is causally irrelevant and mental properties are, in a certain sense, epiphenomena (three reasons for thinking that mental properties are causally irrelevant are discussed in section 4b). Following Brian McLaughlin, one can thus distinguish between event– or token-epiphenomenalism on the one hand and property– or type-epiphenomenalism on the other (see McLaughlin 1989, 1994). According to the event- or token-epiphenomenalism defended by Huxley, concrete physical events are causes, but mental events cannot cause anything. According to the kind of property- or type-epiphenomenalism that threatens modern non-reductive physicalism, events are causes in virtue of their physical properties, but no event is a cause in virtue of its mental properties. If event-epiphenomenalism is wrong, mental events can be causes; but if they are causes solely in virtue of their physical properties, property-epiphenomenalism is still true, and some consider this to be no less disconcerting than Huxley’s original epiphenomenalism (see

4. Arguments for Epiphenomenalism

Arguments in favor of a philosophical theory typically focus on its advantages compared to other theories—that it can explain more phenomena or that it provides a more economical or a more unifying explanation of the relevant phenomena. There are no arguments for epiphenomenalism in that sense. Epiphenomenalism is just not an attractive or desirable theory. Rather, it is a theory of last resort into which people are pushed by the feeling that all the alternatives are even less plausible. Even epiphenomenalists admit that, from the first-person point of view of a thinking and feeling subject, they don’t like it. Why, then, do people embrace epiphenomenalism?

a. The No-Gap-Argument

Epiphenomenalism required an intellectual climate in which two apparently discordant beliefs about the world were equally well entrenched: a dualism with respect to mind and body on the one hand and a scientific naturalism or mechanism concerning the body on the other. To most thinkers of the eighteenth and nineteenth century, it seemed obvious that human beings enjoy a mental life that resists incorporation into a purely materialist ontology. Our thoughts, sensations, desires etc. just seemed to be too dissimilar from ordinary physical phenomena for them to be “nothing but” physical phenomena. At the same time, however, science saw the advent of a decidedly naturalistic attitude towards the human body, motivated by the successes of mechanistic physics in other areas and characterized by a desire to identify the underlying causal structure of every observed phenomenon in terms of matter and motion alone. In particular, neurophysiological research was unable to reveal any mental influence upon the brain or the body. Eventually, with the demise of vitalism regarding the forces governing animate life, the conception of the physical as a causally closed system, in which physical forces are the only forces, became almost universally accepted. When combined with the naturalistic assumption that human beings are a part of the physical world and governed by its laws, this left no room for any causal efficacy of our mental life. There simply seemed to be “no gaps” (McLaughlin 1994, 278) in the causal mechanisms that could be filled by non-physical phenomena. Therefore, epiphenomenalism can be regarded as the inevitable result of the attempt to combine a scientific naturalism with respect to the body with a dualism with respect to the mind. Human beings are exhaustively governed by physical laws so that no non-physical causes must be invoked to explain their behavior, but since they are also subjects of non-physical minds, these minds must be causally irrelevant. Whenever our trust in the causal authority of the physical is overwhelmed by our first-person experience of ourselves as creatures with an essentially non-physical mind, epiphenomenalism is waiting in the wings. This holds for Huxley’s version of epiphenomenalism no less than for modern property-epiphenomenalism–both are driven by the idea that some of our mental life is distinct from that part of the physical that is the ultimate and only authority with regard to causation.

b. Arguments from the Debate about Mental Causation

Those who defend epiphenomenalism typically do so because they fail to see how it could not be true. How could our mind make a causal difference to our physical body? This is the so-called “problem of mental causation.” That there is mental causation is part and parcel of our self-conception as freely deliberating agents that are the causal origins of their actions and do what they do because they have the beliefs and desires they have. Yet, the How of mental causation constitutes a serious philosophical problem. Its solution requires an account that shows exactly how the mental fits into the causal structure of an otherwise physical world in such a way as to exert a genuine causal influence, and any such account faces at least three difficulties. First, causation seems to require laws, but there are grounds for denying the existence of appropriate laws connecting the mental and the physical (the “Argument from the Anomaly of the Mental”). Second, causation is arguably a local or intrinsic affair, while in the case of beliefs and desires, for instance, those aspects constitutive of them insofar as they are mental are arguably relational or extrinsic (the “Argument from Anti-Individualism”). Third, we do not understand how the mental can be causally efficacious without coming into conflict with other parts of the causal structure we know (or at least suspect) to play an indispensable causal role in the production of physical effects (the “Argument from Causal Exclusion”).

i. The Argument from the Anomaly of the Mental

The Anomalous Monism of Donald Davidson was one of the earliest versions of non-reductive physicalism (see Davidson 1970). Davidson devised it to reconcile the idea that the mental is part of the physical causal network with the idea that we are autonomous agents in voluntary control of our actions. The problem is that the latter idea requires, while the former explicitly denies, that “[m]ental events such as perceivings, rememberings, decisions, and actions resist capture in the nomological net of physical theory” (Davidson 1970, 207). On the one hand, since cause and effect must always fall under a strict causal law, if the mental is to be causally efficacious, it must be subject to strict laws. On the other hand, we can be autonomous agents only if the mental is not part of the potentially deterministic nomological network of physics; true autonomy requires that there be no strict laws connecting mental events with other mental events or with physical events and that the concepts necessary to describe, explain and predict actions and to ascribe attitudes not be reducible by definition or natural law to the concepts employed by physical sciences (Davidson 1970, 212). The exact nature of Davidson’s argument for this “anomaly of the mental” is a matter of dispute, but his idea seems to be that the existence of strict psychophysical or psychological laws, together with the strict and potentially deterministic physical laws, would be at odds with the essentially holistic and rational nature of belief attributions (Davidson 1970, 219-221.) If causation requires causes and effects to fall under strict laws, and if there are no strict laws concerning mental events, mental causation seems to be impossible. This is the “Argument from the Anomaly of the Mental.” One response would be to abandon the requirement that causes and effects must fall under strict laws. Another response would be to retain the causal law requirement but to deny that the mental is anomalous in the relevant sense. Davidson himself did neither of these. His Anomalous Monism was designed to show that mental causation is in fact compatible with the causal law requirement and the absence of strict psychological and psychophysical laws. Davidson derived Anomalous Monism from the following three seemingly inconsistent premises: (1) Principle of Causal Interaction: At least some mental events causally interact with physical events. (2) Principle of the Nomological Character of Causality: Events related as cause and effect fall under strict causal laws. (3) Principle of the Anomalism of the Mental: There are no strict psychological or psychophysical laws on the basis of which mental events can be predicted and explained. (1) and (2) apparently imply the falsity of (3): “it is natural to reason that the first two principles […] together imply that at least some mental events can be predicted and explained on the basis of laws, while the principle of the anomalism of the mental denies this” (Davidson 1970, 209). Davidson’s goal was to interpret (1), (2), and (3) in such a way that they are not only consistent but jointly entail that particular mental events which causally interact with other events are identical to physical events. According to Davidson, (1) is an extensional claim about a relation between particular events: although the assertion of the causal relation between two events c and e requires describing them, the causal relation itself holds “no matter how they are described” (Davidson 1993, 6; 1970, 215). In contrast, (2) and (3) concern laws. Since “laws are linguistic” (Davidson 1970, 215) and thus an intensional affair, particular events fall under laws “only as described.” (2) says that whenever two events c and e are related as cause and effect, there are descriptions “d_c” and “d_e” of c and e, respectively, under which c and e instantiate a causal law, although there may be descriptions “d*_c” and “d*_e” under which they do not instantiate a causal law (although “d*_c caused d*_e” is nevertheless a true singular causal statement). Given this, it is easy to see why Davidson thinks that (1), (2), and (3) entail that mental events which causally interact with other events must be identical to physical events. By (1), some mental event m causes or is caused by a physical event p. By (2), m and p must therefore instantiate a strict causal law. That is, there must be descriptions “d_m” and “d_p” of m and p, respectively, such that “d_m-events cause d_p-events” (or “d_p-events cause d_m-events”) is a strict causal law. By (3), this can only be a physical law. Hence, “d_m” and “d_p” must belong to the vocabulary of physics. Since events are mental or physical “only as described” and since m has with “d_m” at least one physical description, m must thus be a physical event (Davidson 1970, 224). However, while causation may admittedly be an extensional relation between particular events, many philosophers have argued that which causal relations an event enters into is determined by which event-types it falls under. The singing’s being the singing of a high C, it seems, is causally relevant for its causing the shattering, while its being the singing of the word “freedom” is not. According to Anomalous Monism, Davidson’s critics claim, only the strict laws of physics can be causal laws, and hence events seem to be causally related only in virtue of falling under physical event-types, rendering mental event-types causally irrelevant:

Davidson’s argument for Anomalous Monism shows that any causal relation involving a mental event and a physical event holds only because a strict physical law subsumes the two events under physical kinds or descriptions. The fact that the mental event is a mental event, or that it is the kind of mental event that it is, appears to be entirely immaterial to the causal relation. […] Individual mental events […] do have causal efficacy, but only because they fall under physical kinds, and the mental kinds that they are have […] nothing to say about what causal relations they enter into. The causal structure of the world is wholly determined by the physical kinds and properties instantiated by events of this world. (Kim 2003b, 126)

This is a prominent objection against Anomalous Monism (see, for example, Honderich 1982; Kim 1989a, 1993a; Sosa 1993). Anomalous Monism may avoid token- or event-physicalism, but it seems to succumb to type- or property-epiphenomenalism: mental events, by being identical to physical events, are causally efficacious, but that they are the kind of mental event they are adds nothing to their causal efficacy (for responses on behalf of Anomalous Monism see Campbell 1997, 1998; Davidson 1993; Lepore & Loewer 1987; McLaughlin 1989).

ii. The Argument from Anti-Individualism

Anti-individualism or externalism holds that the content of mental states and the meaning of some natural language terms is a relational, or extrinsic, rather than a local, or intrinsic, property (see Burge 1979; Putnam 1975). What are local or relational properties? Suppose Sarah weighs 110 pounds, is four foot five, has blond hair and is taller than Jack. The first three properties seem to be local in the sense that they supervene upon Sarah’s internal make-up and Sarah can acquire or loose them only if she herself undergoes some change. The fourth property, in contrast, seems to be relational in the sense that Sarah has it only by courtesy of certain external facts, namely, only if there is someone else, Jack, who is smaller than she is. If Jack grows tall enough, Sarah loses the property of being taller than Jack, although she herself does not undergo any change. According to Hilary Putnam, meanings of natural kind terms are relational properties (see Putnam 1975). What Sarah means by an utterance of, say, “water,” “tiger,” “elm,” or “gold” is not determined solely by her internal make-up, but also by her environment. Consequently, such terms can mean different things in the mouth of molecularly identical twins that are indistinguishable with regard to their local properties. Meanings “just ain’t in the head,” as Putnam famously put it. Moreover, the contents of the corresponding thoughts seem to be relational properties, too: what Sarah believes when she has a belief she would express as, say, “Water is wet” is determined by the way the world is and not solely by how things are “inside” her. Tyler Burge went even further and argued that natural kind terms are not the only terms whose meaning is determined by external factors and that not only differences in the physical environment can affect the meaning of a term or the content of a belief, but also differences in a subject’s historical, linguistic, or social environment (see Burge 1979). Externalism or anti-individualism makes mental causation problematic. Causality seems to be an entirely local affair in the sense that a system’s behavior apparently supervenes upon its internal make-up. Consequently, two systems exactly alike in all internal respects will behave in exactly the same way, so that relational properties like being a genuine dollar coin or being a photo of Sarah do not seem to make a difference to the behavior of, say, a vending machine or a scanner: as long as the piece of metal inserted into a vending machine has a certain set of local properties, the vending machine will exhibit a certain behavior, no matter whether the piece of mental inserted is a genuine dollar coin or a counterfeit, and a scanner will produce a certain distribution of pixels on the screen, no matter whether the object scanned is a photo of Sarah or a piece of paper locally indistinguishable from a photo of Sarah. The assumption that causation is a local affair, when combined with externalism or anti-individualism, leads to epiphenomenalism: the meaning or content of a mental state, being a relational property, threatens to be as irrelevant for our behavior as the property of being a genuine dollar coin is for the behavior of a vending machine. In order to avoid epiphenomenalism, we must either eschew anti-individualism or show how relational mental properties can make a causal difference. Jerry Fodor tried to explicate a notion of “narrow content” according to which the mental states of intrinsically indistinguishable subjects must have the same contents, although their relationally individuated “wide contents” may differ (see Fodor 1987, ch. 1, 1991). Since narrow contents supervene upon the intrinsic make-up of a subject, Fodor held, the charge of epiphenomenalism can be avoided. However, he has recently given up on this idea because it proved extremely difficult to say exactly what narrow contents are (see Fodor 1995). Frank Jackson and Philip Pettit argue that relational properties can be causally relevant in virtue of figuring in so called “program explanations,” although strictly speaking the causal work is done solely by local properties (see, for example, Jackson & Pettit 1990). In a similar vein, Lynne Rudder Baker and Tyler Burge claim that the charge of epiphenomenalism “just melts away” (Baker 1993, 93) if we acknowledge that our explanatory practice which undoubtedly treats explanations in terms of relational properties as causal explanations trumps any metaphysical armchair argument to the contrary (see Baker 1993, 1995; Burge 1993). And Fred Dretske argues that while the triggering causes of behavior are always local, relational mental properties can make a causal difference in virtue of being structuring causes of behavior, that is, in virtue of structuring a causal system in such a way that the occurrence of a triggering neurophysiological cause causes a given behavioral effect (see, for example, Dretske 1988).

iii. The Argument from Causal Exclusion

Most philosophers nowadays defend some version of non-reductive physicalism. According to non-reductive physicalism, all scientifically respectable entities are physical entities, where entities which cannot be straightforwardly reduced to physical entities—mental events or properties, for instance—are physical at least in the broad sense that they supervene or depend upon physical entities. Non-reductive physicalism is attractive because it promises to respect the naturalistic attitude characteristic of our modern scientific time while at the same time also preserving our self-conception as autonomous agents. For decades, however, Jaegwon Kim has argued that non-reductive physicalists unwittingly commit themselves to epiphenomenalism. His master argument is the so-called Causal Exclusion Argument, which he uses as a reductio ad absurdum of non-reductive physicalism: if the mental were merely supervenient upon but not reducible to the physical, as non-reductive physicalism holds, it would be causally irrelevant (barring overdetermination). Non-reductive physicalism is thus unable to steer a safe path between the Scylla of reductionism on the one hand and the Charybdis of epiphenomenalism on the other, so that those unwilling to embrace outright reductionism are forced to accept epiphenomenalism. Kim’s most recent version of the Causal Exclusion Argument, the so-called Supervenience Argument, has two stages. Stage one holds that mental properties (or, rather, their instances–a qualification that will be omitted from now on) can cause other mental properties only if they can cause physical properties. Stage two then holds that mental properties can cause physical properties only if they are reducible to physical properties or genuinely overdetermining. Since overdetermination can be ruled out, the only remaining alternatives are “reduction or causal impotence” (Kim 2005, 54). Suppose a mental property M causes a mental property M*. Since mind-body supervenience “is a shared minimum commitment of all positions that are properly called physicalist” (Kim 2005, 13), non-reductive physicalism must posit a physical supervenience base P* of M* which is (non-causally) sufficient for M*. What, then, is responsible for M*’s occurrence—M or P*? There appears to be “a tension between vertical determination and horizontal causation” (Kim 2003a, 153): “under the assumption of mind-body supervenience, M* occurs because its supervenience base P* occurs, and as long as P* occurs, M* must occur […] regardless of whether or not an instance of M preceded it. This puts the claim of M to be a cause of M* in jeopardy: P* alone seems fully responsible for, and capable of accounting for, the occurrence of M*” (Kim 1998, 42). The upshot of this first stage of the argument is that the tension between M and P* can be resolved only by accepting that “M caused M* by causing its supervenience base P*” (Kim 2005, 40). Stage two then goes on to argue that mental-to-physical causation is impossible. Given the so-called causal closure of the physical, P* must have a sufficient and completely physical cause P, leading to a competition between M and P for the role of P*’s cause. Barring overdetermination, M seems bound to loose this competition: if P is a sufficient cause of P*, then once P is instantiated all that is required for P* to occur is done and there is nothing left for M to contribute, causally speaking. This completes stage two of the Causal Exclusion Argument. Both steps together seem to lead to epiphenomenalism–unless mental properties are reducible or genuinely overdetermining, they must be causally inert, so that with the overdetermination option and the reduction option ruled out, epiphenomenalism is the inevitable consequence. In response, non-reductive physicalists have offered compatibilist accounts of mental causation designed to explain how irreducible mental properties can play a substantial causal role in the production of physical effects, given that the causal work is done solely by physical properties. The common core of these attempts is the idea that there is some compatibilist condition C such that (1.) fulfilling C is sufficient for being causally relevant; (2.) properties which do not do any real causal work can fulfill C; (3.) C can be fulfilled by two or more properties without leading to any kind of “causal competition;” and (4.) mental properties can fulfill C. Prominent compatibilist candidates for C include figuring in counterfactual dependencies (see LePore & Loewer 1987) or program explanations (see Jackson & Pettit 1990), being a determinable of the physical properties which do the causal work (see Yablo 1992), or falling under non-strict causal laws (see Fodor 1989; McLaughlin 1989).

c. Libet’s Experiments

Intuition tells us that we, as conscious selves, are in charge of our actions, and the man in the street finds the idea that consciousness is a causally irrelevant by-product of brain processes preposterous. Empirical scientists, however, have long questioned these assumptions. Many of them think that the brain causes our actions and then makes us think that it was us who did it: “The unique human convenience of conscious thoughts that preview our actions gives us the privilege of feeling we willfully cause what we do. In fact, unconscious and inscrutable mechanisms create both conscious thought about action and the action, and also produce the sense of will we experience by perceiving the thought as cause of the action” (Wegner 2002, 98). No empirical research has provoked more philosophical discussion than Benjamin Libet’s experiments concerning the relationship between unconscious brain activity and the subjective feeling of volition during the initiation of simple motor actions (see Libet et al. 1983; Libet 1985). Previous research had shown that actions that are perceived to be the result of a conscious feeling of volition are also preceded by a pattern of brain activity known as the “readiness potential.” The question Libet and his colleagues wanted to answer was: What comes first—the feeling of volition or the readiness potential? They instructed subjects to perform a simple motor activity, like pressing a button, within a certain time frame at an arbitrary moment decided by them (“Let the urge to act appear on its own any time without any preplanning or concentration on when to act”; Libet et al. 1983, 625). The subjects were asked to remember exactly when they made the decision, when they were first aware of the “urge to act,” by noticing the position of a dot circling a clock face (the “clock” being a cathode ray oscilloscope modified so as to be able to measure time intervals of roughly fifty milliseconds). The time when the action was carried out, when the subjects actually pressed the button, was measured by electronically recording the position of the dot. On average, it took about 200 milliseconds from the first conscious feeling of voliton to the actual pressing of the button. But Libet and his collaborators also recorded the subjects’ brain activity by means of an EEG. They found that an increased electrical activity, the so-called “readiness potential,” was built up (primarily in the secondary motor cortex) on average approximately 500 milliseconds before the button was pushed, and that means approximately 300 milliseconds before the subjects felt the conscious “urge to act” (Libet’s experiments have been repeated and improved several times; see, e.g. Keller & Heckhausen 1990; Haggard & Eimer 1999; Miller & Trevena 2002; Trevena & Miller 2002). It is tempting to interpret this result as showing that the allegedly free decision of the subject was in fact determined by unconscious brain processes and that, at least insofar as decisions to act are concerned, our mind is a mere epiphenomenon, but it remains a controversial issue exactly what philosophical consequences we ought to draw from Libet’s experiments (see Pockett et al. 2006).

5. Arguments against Epiphenomenalism

Epiphenomenalism has had few friends. It has been deemed “thoughtless and incoherent” (Taylor 1927, 198), “unintelligible” (Benecke 1901, 26), “quite impossible to believe” (Taylor 1963, 28) and “truly incredible” (McLaughlin 1994, 284). The resistance stems from the fact that many think that if epiphenomenalism were correct, we could not be the kind of being we are and we could not occupy the place in the world we occupy. We would instead be at the mercy of our brains and we would have to say that our actions are all our brains’ actions and that ultimately “we” have nothing to do with them.

If the eyebrows are raised they are not raised by us. What is done is not done by us. […] We go piggy-back, and we cannot get off. Where it goes, we go. What’s “it”? The body/brain is “it.” “It” is not us, is the point. Epiphenomenalism would be the ruin of the self and that self’s life. […] Our supposed self is illusory, and we are deluded. […] We lose ourselves when consciousness ceases to be effective in what we chose. (Hyslop 1998, 68)

In his book The Fundamental Questions of Philosophy, Alfred Cyril Ewing introduced epiphenomenalism as a theory that can be disposed of in a “conclusive fashion” (Ewing 1953, 127): “That epiphenomenalism is false is assumed in all practical life […] and it is silly to adopt a philosophy the denial of which is implied by us every time we do anything” (Ewing 1953, 128). But what exactly is it that renders epiphenomenalism so evidently absurd?

a. The Argument from Counterintuitiveness

Epiphenomenalism is counterintuitive. There’s no doubt about that. Yet, philosophy, like all science, is not concerned with intuitiveness but with truth, and that a theory is counterintuitive does not show that it is not true. In fact, a host of widely accepted and feted theories are counterintuitive at first and some remain so forever: the Copernican system, the Freudian theory of the unconscious, Einstein’s theories of special and general relativity or quantum mechanics. Einstein’s theory of relativity, for instance, is much less intuitive than Newtonian physics, but ultimately the fate of a theory depends on whether there are good arguments in favor of it, not on whether it is intuitive. If there are reasons for taking epiphenomenalism seriously, then we should do that, just as we do it in the case of the theory of relativity: “Epiphenomenalism may be counterintuitive, but it is not obviously false, so if a sound argument forces it on us, we should accept it” (Chalmers 1996, 159).

b. The Argument from Introspection

It might seem as if we can be introspectively aware of chains of mental occurrences, one of which is causing the other, for instance when we reason through an argument, write a piece of prose, or acquire a new belief by inferring it from previously held beliefs. We just know, it seems, that in these cases there is mental causation. The same may be said to be true of various chains of occurrences both inside and outside of our mind, for instance when volitions give rise to appropriate behavior, when a pain results in a wincing, or when fear makes our heart beat faster–one might say that in these cases, too, we have some immediate cognitive access to the causal efficacy of the mental. If we could indeed be in some sense “directly acquainted” with the fact that such sequences are the result of genuinely causal processes, epiphenomenalism would not be an option. Yet, our awareness of regular successions does not and cannot reveal their causal nature. The awareness of the psychological or psychophysical sequences that make up our everyday life is no more awareness of causal processes than awareness of the sequence of shadows a moving car casts (Lachs 1963, 189). Whatever those who hold that epiphenomenalism is “incompetent to take account of the obvious facts of mental life” (Taylor 1927, 198) mean, they cannot mean that it is contradicted by our immediate cognitive access to our mind’s causal effectiveness, because there is no phenomenological difference between a situation in which epiphenomenalism is false and a situation in which epiphenomenalism is true.

c. The Argument from Evolution

One of the earliest objections to epiphenomenalism starts with the observation that we have the properties we have because they contributed positively to our ancestors’ differential fitness and that a property which endows an organism with an evolutionary advantage must make a causal difference to its survival. Since we have mental properties, while our ancient ancestors did not, the argument continues, these properties must have evolved over time and therefore must be capable of making a causal difference (this argument is frequently attributed to Popper & Eccles 1977, but it was endorsed already by James 1879). Epiphenomenalists respond that mental properties may have evolved as nomologically necessary by-products of adaptive traits. A polar bear’s having a heavy coat decreases its fitness (by slowing it down), but is nevertheless an evolved trait because it was an inevitable by-product of a highly adaptive trait, namely, having a warm coat: “Having a heavy coat is an unavoidable concomitant of having a warm coat […], and the advantages for survival of having a warm coat outweighed the disadvantages of having a heavy one” (Jackson 1982, 134). Likewise, it could be that we enjoy our mental life because its neurophysiological causes contributed positively to our ancestors’ differential fitness by making them “fitter” compared to those who lacked such neurophysiological equipment. Maybe we have a mind because it was evolutionary adaptive to have a big brain and it is nomologically impossible to have a big brain without having a mind. The problem with this response is that while we understand perfectly well why polar bears can have warm coats only in virtue of having heavy coats, we have little or no idea why it should be necessary to have a mind in order to have a big brain. Why should of all neurophysiological structures only those with a causally irrelevant mind as by-product be able to do what was required for our ancestors’ survival? If a company claims that religion is not an employment criterion, but it turns out that all its employees are of the same religion, that cries out for an explanation, and the same holds if the epiphenomenalist claims that although our mind is totally ineffective, during the course of evolution only brain structures have evolved that are accompanied by a mind as a by-product.

d. The Argument from the Impossibility of Knowledge of Other Minds

Another problem is that epiphenomenalism seems to render our standard response to the other minds problem impossible. According to that response, our belief that our fellow human beings have a mental life similar to ours is justified by an argument from analogy, stated in its classic form by John Stuart Mill and Bertrand Russell (Mill 1865, 190-191; Russell 1948, 208-209 & 501-504). Since our own body and outward behavior are observably similar to the body and the behavior of our fellow human beings, we are justified by analogy in believing that they enjoy a mental life similar to ours. The idea is to infer like mental causes from like behavioral effects and this does not work for the epiphenomenalist who denies that there are any mental causes. (This is an objection to epiphenomenalism only if the argument from analogy does indeed provide a good solution to the other minds problem, and that is far from obvious–notoriously, inductions based on a single positive instance are problematic and in the case of other minds there is no independent way of verifying the conclusion.) The epiphenomenalist can employ the same strategy as in the case of the argument from evolution and insist that our inference to the mental life of others need not advert to causality all the way up. If the similar behavior and the similar body of others provide evidence for anything, they provide evidence for the assumption that they are in physical states relevantly similar to those which, in us, are causally responsible for our mental life. This inference is not one from outward behavior to inward mental causes, but from outward behavior to inward neurophysiological causes and from there on further to inward mental effects, but it seems that it is no less reliable (see Benecke 1901; Jackson 1982).

e. The Argument from Davidson’s Reasons for / Reasons for which Distinction

Davidson famously pointed out that I may have a reason for performing an action, perform that action, and yet not perform it for that reason (Davidson 1963, 9). Suppose, for instance, I want to meet my mistress and I believe that I can attain this goal by giving her a call; suppose I also have a second-order desire to get rid off my first-order desire and I believe that I can attain this goal by calling my psychiatrist. When I finally walk to the phone, it seems, I have a reason for doing so (my first-order desire plus my corresponding belief) which is not the reason for which I walk to phone (Wilson 1997, 72). According to Davidson, the reasons for an action and the reasons for which the action is performed can be easily distinguished: the reasons for which an action is performed are those which cause the action. This explanation is not available to the epiphenomenalist who holds that no reason ever causes an action. (Again, this is an objection against epiphenomenalism only if Davidson’s distinction makes sense; see Latham 2003 for the view that it doesn’t.) In response, however, the epiphenomenalist can hold that the reasons for which an action is performed are those that are caused by the neurophysiological cause of the action.

f. Other Arguments

Knowledge, memory, justification, meaning and reference all seem to require the causal efficacy of what is known, remembered, believed, meant or picked out. How, for instance, could we say that Sarah knows that there is orange juice in the fridge or that her belief that there is orange juice in the fridge is justified, if her belief were in no way causally connected to the fridge or the orange juice? The causal relation does not have to be direct–it may be that Sarah’s mother saw the orange juice in the fridge, told it to Sarah’s sister who in turn told it to Sarah, causing her thereby to believe that there is orange juice in the fridge. Most of our knowledge depends upon such indirect causal chains. We are not in direct causal contact with Plato, the cholera, Caesar’s crossing of the Rubicon or the outbreak of World War I, but we can have knowledge about these things because we are linked to them by long causal chains starting with someone who was in direct causal contact with them. According to a causal theory of knowledge, knowledge is impossible without such a causal chain, and something similar holds for justification, memory, meaning, and reference. If Sarah believes that it rained on February 1, 1953 in Amsterdam, but the rain on February 1, 1953 in Amsterdam is not causally related in any way to Sarah’s belief, then it seems that her belief cannot be justified; if the rain on that day is not causally related to Sarah’s current mental states in any way, then it seems that she cannot remember the rain on February 1, 1953 in Amsterdam; and one reason why Sarah’s twin on Putnam’s famous Twin Earth (see Putnam 1975) cannot refer to water and why by using the word “water” she cannot mean water is that she never did causally interact with water. If knowledge, justification, memory, meaning and reference require a causal contact with what is known, believed, remembered, meant and picked out, epiphenomenalism implies that we cannot have knowledge of or justified beliefs about mental states (our own or those of others), that we cannot remember past mental states, cannot refer to mental states and cannot make meaningful statements about them. However, it is absurd to hold that Sarah cannot know that she is having a toothache, that she cannot remember the feeling she had when she fell in love for the first time etc. Moreover, if a causal theory of meaning or reference is correct, then the very statements the epiphenomenalist uses to formulate her position are meaningless: “if the mental contributes nothing to the way in which the linguistic practices involving ‘[psychological’ terms are developed and sustained in the speech-community […] then [this] would deprive the epiphenomenalist of the linguistic resources to enunciate his thesis” (Foster 1996, 191). To the extent that epiphenomenalism aspires to make a meaningful statement about the nature of our mental life, it would thus be self-refuting since that is impossible if it is true (see Robinson 2006 for a discussion of this problem and for a reply on behalf of epiphenomenalism). Even if the epiphenomenalist could somehow formulate her position, it would be a pointless exercise from her point of view to try to convince us of its truth, because if she is right, rational considerations can have no causal influence upon our beliefs and actions. In response, the epiphenomenalist could argue that a causal chain cannot always be required because Sarah can know, justifiably believe or remember that bachelors are unmarried and that two plus two equals four, or use the term “the biggest star in the universe” to refer to an object even if she never causally interacted with bachelors, the number two or the biggest star in the universe. The problem, however, is that our knowledge and our memories of and our talk about our mental states seem to be fundamentally different from the typical examples of knowledge, memory, or reference that are possible without a causal contact. As Dieter Birnbacher points out (before he goes on the defend epiphenomenalism against this charge): “[such] examples show that a causal theory of knowledge cannot claim to cover all and every kind of knowledge. But this doesn’t mean that a causal theory of knowledge is implausible for other, and admittedly central, kinds of knowledge such as knowledge by perception and introspection” (Birnbacher 2006, 123-124). The epiphenomenalist has to offer a constructive account of what, if not a causal relation, grounds knowledge, justification, memory, meaning, and reference in the case of mental states. According to David Chalmers, for instance, in the case of phenomenal mental states, knowledge and justification are an immediate consequence of the fact that we have these experiences: “it is having the experiences that justifies the beliefs [about our experiences]” (Chalmers 1996, 196), because “[t]o have an experience is automatically to stand in some sort of intimate epistemic relation to the experience” (Chalmers 1996, 196-197). Since the epiphenomenalist admits that we have experiences and since we cannot have experiences without knowing that we have them, the epiphenomenalist can admit that we can have knowledge of our experiences. Chalmers also develops a non-causal account of memory and reference (Chalmers 1996, 192-203; see Robinson 1982, 2006 for competing but related proposals). Although there may be problems with such accounts, it certainly seems plausible to ask why the opponents of epiphenomenalism insist that the relation that grounds knowledge, justification, memory, reference and meaning must be causal through and through. According to the epiphenomenalist, when Sarah knows that she has a toothache or remembers the feeling she had when she first fell in love, there is a causal chain which leads from the neurophysiological cause of her toothache or her feeling to her current state of knowledge or memory. Why should such a chain be less capable of grounding knowledge or memory than a causal chain which starts with the toothache or the feeling itself? To insist without further explanation that the link has to be causal through and through does not tell us what the apparently indispensable je-ne-sais-quois about such a causal link is, without which knowledge, memory etc. are supposed to be impossible (see Pauen 2006 and Staudacher 2006 for further discussion). There are various objections against epiphenomenalism, nearly all of which are based upon the claim that this or that undeniable fact would be impossible if epiphenomenalism were true. In response, the epiphenomenalist typically points out that the causal relation she says holds between mental states and their neurophysiological correlates ensures that whenever her opponents appeal to a mental cause to account for some apparently undeniable fact, she can appeal to a physical cause which is correlated with the alleged mental cause with nomological necessity and does exactly the same causal job.

6. References and Further Reading

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Baker, L. (1995). Explaining Attitudes. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Benecke, E. (1901). On the aspect theory of the relation of mind to body. Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, 1, 18-44.
Birnbacher, D. (2006). Causal interpretations of correlations between neural and conscious events. Journal of Consciousness Studies, 13, 115-128.
Bonnet, C. (1755). Essai de Psychologie. Ou Considerations de l’Ame, sur l’Habitude et sur l’Education. London. Reprinted 1978, Hildesheim: Georg Olms Verlag.
Burge, T. (1979). Individualism and the mental. Midwest Studies in Philosophy, 4, 73-121.
Burge, T. (1993). Mind-body causation and explanatory practice, Mental Causation, hrsg. v. J. Heil & A. Mele, 97-120. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
Campbell, N. (1997). Anomalous monism and the charge of epiphenomenalism. Dialectica, 52, 23-39.
Campbell, N. (1998). The standard objection to anomalous monism. Australasian Journal of Philosophy, 75, 373-382.
Chalmers, D. (1996). The Conscious Mind: In Search of a Fundamental Theory. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Davidson, D. (1963). Actions, reasons, and causes. Journal of Philosophy, 60, 685-700. Reprinted in Essays on Actions and Events, 3-19. Oxford: Clarendon Press 1980.
Davidson, D. (1970). Mental events, Experience and Theory, ed. L. Foster & J.W. Swanson, 79-101. Amherst, MA: The University of Massachusetts Press and Duckworth. Reprinted in Essays on Actions and Events, 207-225. Oxford: Clarendon Press 1980.
Davidson, D. (1993). Thinking causes, Mental Causation, ed. J. Heil A. Mele, 3-17. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
Dretske, F. (1988). Explaining Behavior: Reasons in a World of Causes. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Dretske, F. (1989). Reasons and causes. Philosophical Perspectives, 3, 1-15.
Ewing, A. (1953). The Fundamental Problems of Philosophy. New York: Macmillan.
Fodor, J. (1987). Psychosemantics. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Fodor, J. (1989). Making mind matter more. Philosophical Topics, 17, 59-79. Reprinted in A Theory of Content and Other Essays, 137-160. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press 1990.
Fodor, J. (1991). A modal argument for narrow content. Journal of Philosophy, 88, 5-26.
Fodor, J. (1995). The Elm and the Expert: Mentalese and its Semantics. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Foster, J. (1996). The Immaterial Self. London: Routledge.
Haggard, P. & Eimer, M. (1999). On the relation between brain potentials and the awareness of voluntary movements. Experimental Brain Research, 126, 128-133.
Hodgson, S. (1965). Time and Space: A Metaphysical Essay. London: Longmans, Green.
Honderich, T. (1982). The argument for anomalous monism. Analysis, 42, 59-64.
Huxley, T.H. (1874). On the hypothesis that animals are automata, and its history. Fortnightly Review, 22, 555-580. Reprinted in Collected Essays: Volume I, Method and Results, 195-250. London: Macmillan 1893.
Huxley, T.H. (1898). Hume with Helps to the Study of Berkeley. New York: D. Appleton and Company.
Hyslop, A. (1998). Methodological epiphenomenalism. Australasian Journal of Philosophy, 76, 61-70.
Jackson, F. (1982). Epiphenomenal qualia. Philosophical Quarterly, 32, 127-136.
Jackson, F. & Pettit, P. (1990). Program explanation: A general perspective. Analysis, 50, 107-117.
James, W. (1879). Are we automata? Mind, 4, 1-22.
Keller, I. & Heckhausen, H. (1990). Readiness potentials preceding spontaneous motor acts: Voluntary vs. involuntary control. Electroencephalography and Clinical Neurophysiology, 76, 351-361.
Kim, J. (1989a). The myth of nonreductive materialism. Proceedings of the American Philosophical Association, 63, 31-47. Reprinted in Supervenience and Mind: Selected Philosophical Essays, 265-284. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press 1993.
Kim, J. (1993a). Can supervenience and ‘non-strict laws’ save anomalous monism?, Mental Causation, ed. J. Heil & A. Mele, 19-26. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
Kim, J. (1998). Mind in a Physical World: An Essay on the Mind-Body Problem and Mental Causation. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Kim, J. (2003a). Blocking causal drainage and other maintenance chores with mental causation. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 67, 151-176.
Kim, J. (2003b). Philosophy of psychology, Donald Davidson, ed. K. Ludwig, 113-136. Oxford: Clarendon.
Kim, J. (2005). Physicalism – Or Something Near Enough. Cambridge, MA: Princeton University Press.
Lachs, J. (1963). The impotent mind. Review of Metaphysics, 17, 187-199.
Latham, N. (2003). Are there any nonmotivating reasons for action?, Physicalism and Mental Causation: The Metaphysics of Mind and Action, ed. S. Walter & H.D. Heckmann, 273-294. Thoverton: Imprint Academic.
LePore, E. & Loewer, B. (1987). Mind matters. Journal of Philosophy, 84, 630-642.
Lewis, D. (1983). Extrinsic properties. Philosophical Studies, 44, 197-200.
Libet, B. (1985). Unconscious cerebral initiative and the role of conscious will in voluntary action. Behavioral and Brain Sciences, 8, 529-539.
Libet, B., Gleason, C., Wright, E. & Pearl, D. (1983). Time of conscious intention to act in relation to onset of cerebral activities (readiness-potential): The unconscious initiation of a freely voluntary act. Brain, 106, 623-642.
McLaughlin, B. (1989). Type epiphenomenalism, type dualism, and the causal priority of the physical. Philosophical Perspectives, 3, 109-135.
McLaughlin, B. (1994). Epiphenomenalism, A Companion to the Philosophy of Mind, ed. S. Guttenplan, 277-288. Oxford: Blackwell.
Mill, J.S. (1865). An Examination of Sir William Hamilton’s Philosophy. Collected Works of John Stuart Mill, Vol. 9, ed. J.M. Robson. Toronto: University of Toronto Press, 1979.
Miller, J. & Trevena, J. (2002). Cortical movement preparation and conscious decisions: Averaging artifacts and timing biases. Consciousness and Cognition, 11, 308-313.
Pauen, M. (2006). Feeling causes. Journal of Consciousness Studies, 13, 129-152.
Pockett, S., Banks, W. & Gallagher, S. (2006). Does Consciousness Cause Behavior? Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Popper, K. & Eccles, J. (1977). The Self and Its Brain. New York: Springer.
Putnam, H. (1975). The meaning of ‘meaning’. Minnesota Studies in the Philosophy of Science, 7, 131-193. Reprinted in Mind, Language, and Reality: Philosophical Papers, Vol. 2, 215-271. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press 1975.
Robinson, W. (1982). Causation, sensations and knowledge. Mind, 91, 524-540.
Robinson, W. (2003). Epiphenomenalism, The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Spring 2003 Edition), ed. by E. Zalta.
Robinson, W. (2004). Understanding Phenomenal Consciousness. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Robinson, W. (2006). Knowing epiphenomena. Journal of Consciousness Studies, 13, 85-100.
Russell, B. (1948). Human Knowledge: Its Scope and Limits. London: Allen & Unwin.
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Staudacher, A. (2006). Epistemological challenges to qualia-epiphenomenalism. Journal of Consciousness Studies, 13, 153-175.
Taylor, A. (1927). Plato: The Man and his Work. New York: MacVeagh.
Taylor, R. (1963). Metaphysics. Englewood Cliffs: Prentice Hall.
Trevena, J. & Miller, J. (2002). Cortical movement preparation before and after a conscious decision to move. Consciousness and Cognition, 11, 162-190.
Wegner, D. (2002). The Illusion of Conscious Will. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Wilson, G. (1997). Reasons as Causes for Action, Contemporary Action Theory, ed. G. Holmstrom-Hintikka & R. Tuomela. Dordrecht: Kluwer.
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Author Information

Sven Walter
Email: s.walter@philosophy-online.de
University of Bielefeld
Germany

Confirmation and Induction

The term “confirmation” is used in epistemology and the philosophy of science whenever observational data and evidence “speak in favor of” or support scientific theories and everyday hypotheses. Historically, confirmation has been closely related to the problem of induction, the question of what to believe regarding the future in the face of knowledge that is restricted to the past and present. One view of the relation between confirmation and induction is that the conclusion H of an inductively strong argument with premise E is confirmed by E. If inductive strength comes in degrees and the inductive strength of the argument with premise E and conclusion H is equal to r, then the degree of confirmation of H by E is likewise said to be equal to r.

This article begins by briefly reviewing Hume‘s formulation of the problem of the justification of induction. Then it jumps to the middle of the twentieth century and Hempel‘s pioneering work on confirmation. After looking at Popper’s falsificationism and the hypothetico-deductive method of hypotheses testing, the notion of probability, as it was defined by Kolmogorov, is introduced. Probability theory is the main mathematical tool for Carnap‘s inductive logic as well as for Bayesian confirmation theory. Carnap’s inductive logic is based on a logical interpretation of probability, which is discussed at some length. However, his heroic efforts to construct a logical probability measure in purely syntactical terms can be considered to have failed. Goodman’s new riddle of induction serves to illustrate the shortcomings of such a purely syntactical approach to confirmation. Carnap’s work is nevertheless important because today’s most popular theory of confirmation—Bayesian confirmation theory—is to a great extent the result of replacing Carnap’s logical interpretation of probability with a subjective interpretation as degree of belief qua fair betting ratio. The rest of the article mainly is concerned with Bayesian confirmation theory, although the final section mentions some alternative views on confirmation and induction.

Introduction: Confirmation and Induction
Hempel and the Logic of Confirmation
1. The Ravens Paradox
2. The Logic of Confirmation
Popper’s Falsificationism and Hypothetico-Deductive Confirmation
1. Popper’s Falsificationism
2. Hypothetico-Deductive Confirmation
Inductive Logic
The New Riddle of Induction and the Demise of the Syntactic Approach
Bayesian Confirmation Theory
Taking Stock
References and Further Reading

1. Introduction: Confirmation and Induction

Whenever observational data and evidence speak in favor of, or support, scientific theories or everyday hypotheses, the latter are said to be confirmed by the former. The positive result of an allergy test speaks in favor of, or confirms, the hypothesis that the tested person has the allergy that is tested for. The dark clouds on the sky support, or confirm, the hypothesis that it will be raining soon.

Confirmation takes a qualitative and a quantitative form. Qualitative confirmation is usually construed as a relation, among other things, between three sentences or propositions: evidence E confirms hypothesis H relative to background information B. Quantitative confirmation is, among other things, a relation between evidence E, hypothesis H, background information B, and a number r: E confirms H relative to B to degree r. (Comparative confirmation—H₁ is more confirmed by E₁ relative to B₁ than H₂ by E₂ relative to B₂—is usually derived from a quantitative notion of confirmation, and is not discussed in this article.)

Historically, confirmation has been closely related to the problem of induction, the question of what to believe regarding the future in the face of knowledge that is restricted to the past and present. David Hume gives the classic formulation of the problem of the justification of induction in A Treatise of Human Nature:

Let men be once fully persuaded of these two principles, that there is nothing in any object, consider’d in itself, which can afford us a reason for drawing a conclusion beyond it; and, that even after the observation of the frequent or constant conjunction of objects, we have no reason to draw any inference concerning any object beyond those of which we have had experience; (Hume 1739/2000, book 1, part 3, section 12)

The reason is that any such inference beyond those objects of which we had experience needs to be justified—and, according to Hume, this is not possible.

In order to justify induction one has to provide a deductively valid argument, or an inductively strong argument, whose premises we know to be true, and whose conclusion says that inductively strong arguments lead from true premises to true conclusions (most of the time). (An argument consists of a list of premises P₁, …, P_n and a conclusion C. An argument is deductively valid just in case the truth of the premises logically guarantees the truth of the conclusion. There is no standard definition of an inductively strong argument, but the idea is that the truth of all premises speaks in favor of, or supports, the truth of conclusion.) However, there is no deductively valid argument whose premises we know to be true and whose conclusion says that inductively strong arguments lead from true premises to true conclusions (most of the time). This is so, because all our knowledge is restricted to the past and present, the relevant conclusion is in part about the future, and it is a fact of logic that there are no deductively valid arguments whose premises are restricted to the past and present and whose conclusion is in part about the future. Furthermore, any inductively strong argument presumably has to be inductively strong in the sense of the very principle of induction that is to be justified—and thus begs the question: it is a petitio principii, an argument that presupposes the principle that it derives. For more, see the introductory Skyrms (2000), the intermediate Hacking (2001), and the advanced Howson (2000a).

Neglecting the background information B, as we will mostly do in the following, we can state the link between induction and confirmation as follows. The conclusion H of an inductively strong argument with premise E is confirmed by E. If r quantifies the strength of the inductive argument in question, the degree of confirmation of H by E is equal to r. Let us then start the discussion of confirmation by the first serious attempts to define the notion, and to develop a corresponding logic of confirmation.

2. Hempel and the Logic of Confirmation

a. The Ravens Paradox

According to the Nicod criterion of confirmation (Hempel 1945), universal generalizations of the form “All Fs are Gs,” in symbols ∀x(Fx → Gx), are confirmed by their instances “This particular object a is both F and G,” or in symbols Fa ∧ Ga. (It would be more appropriate to call Fa → Ga rather than Fa ∧ Ga an instance of ∀x(Fx → Gx).) The universal generalization “All ravens are black” is thus said to be confirmed by its instance “a is a black raven.” As “a is a non-black non-raven” is an instance of “All non-black things are non-ravens,” the Nicod criterion says that “a is a non-black non-raven” confirms “All non-black things are non-ravens.” (It is sometimes said that a black raven confirms the ravens hypothesis “All ravens are black.” In this case, confirmation is a relation between a non-linguistic entity—namely, a black raven—and a hypothesis. Conformation is construed as a relation between, among other things, evidential propositions and hypotheses, and so we have to state the above in a clumsier way.)

One of Hempel’s conditions of adequacy for any relation of confirmation is the equivalence condition. It says that logically equivalent hypotheses are confirmed by the same evidential propositions. “All ravens are black” is logically equivalent to “All non-black things are non-ravens.” Therefore a non-black non-raven like a white shoe or a red herring can be used to confirm the ravens-hypothesis “All ravens are black.” Surely, this is absurd—and this is known as the ravens paradox.

Even worse, “All ravens are black,” ∀x(Rx → Bx), is logically equivalent to “All things that are green or not green are not ravens or black,”∀x[(Gx ∨ ¬Gx) → (¬Rx ∨ Bx)]. “a is green or not green, and a is not raven or black” is an instance of this hypothesis. Furthermore, it is logically equivalent to “a is not a raven or a is black.” As everything is green or not green, we get the similarly paradoxical result that an object which is not a raven or which is black—anything but a non-black raven which could be used to falsify the ravens hypothesis is such an object—can be used to confirm the ravens hypothesis that all ravens are black.

Hempel (1945), who discussed these cases of the ravens, concluded that non-black non-ravens (as well as any other object that is not a raven or black) can indeed be used to confirm the ravens hypothesis. He attributed the paradoxical character of this alleged paradox to the psychological fact that we assume there to be far more non-black objects than ravens. However, the notion of confirmation he was explicating was supposed to presuppose no background knowledge whatsoever. An example by Good (1967) shows that such an unrelativized notion of confirmation is not useful (see Hempel 1967, Good 1968).

Others have been led to the rejection of the Nicod criterion. Howson (2000b, 113) considers the hypothesis “Everybody in the room leaves with somebody else’s hat,” which he attributes to Rosenkrantz (1981). If the background contains the information that there are only three individuals a, b, c in the room, then the evidence consisting of the two instances “a leaves with b‘s hat” and “b leaves with a‘s hat” falsifies rather than confirms the hypothesis. Besides pointing to the role played by the background information in this example, Hempel would presumably have stressed that the Nicod criterion has to be restricted to universal generalization in one variable only. Already in his (1945, 13: fn. 1) he notes that R(a, b) ∧ ¬R(a, b) falsifies ∀x∀y(¬[R(x, y) ∧ R(y, x)] → [R(x, y) ∧ ¬R(x, y)]), which is equivalent to ∀x∀xR(x, y), although it satisfies both the antecedent and the consequent of the universal generalization (compare also Carnap 1950/1962, 469f).

b. The Logic of Confirmation

After discussing the ravens, Hempel (1945) considers the following conditions of adequacy for any relation of confirmation:

Entailment Condition: If an evidential proposition E logically implies some hypothesis H, then E confirms H.
Special Consequence Condition: If an evidential proposition E confirms some hypothesis H, and if H logically implies some hypothesis H’, then E also confirms H’.
Special Consistency Condition: If an evidential proposition E confirms some hypothesis H, and if H is not compatible with some hypothesis H’, then E does not confirm H’.
Converse Consequence Condition: If an evidential proposition E confirms some hypothesis H, and if H is logically implied by some hypothesis H’, then E also confirms H’.

(The equivalence condition mentioned above follows from 2 as well as from 4). Hempel then shows that any relation of confirmation satisfying 1, 2, and 4 is trivial in the sense that every evidential proposition E confirms every hypothesis H. This is easily seen as follows. As E logically implies itself, E confirms E according to the entailment condition. The conjunction of E and H, E ∧ H, logically implies E, and so the converse consequence condition entails that E confirms E ∧ H. But E ∧ H logically implies H; thus E confirms H by the special consequence condition. In fact, it suffices that confirmation satisfies 1 and 4 in order to be trivial: E logically implies and, by 1, confirms the disjunction of E and H, E ∨ H. As H logically implies E ∨ H, E confirms H by 4.

Hempel (1945) rejects the converse consequence condition as the culprit rendering trivial any relation of confirmation satisfying 1-4. The latter condition has nevertheless gained popularity in the philosophy of science—partly because it seems to be at the core of the account of confirmation we will discuss next.

3. Popper’s Falsificationism and Hypothetico-Deductive Confirmation

a. Popper’s Falsificationism

Although Popper was an opponent of any kind of induction, his falsificationism gave rise to a qualitative account of confirmation. Popper started by observing that many scientific hypotheses have the form of universal generalizations, say “All metals conduct electricity.” Now there can be no amount of observational data that would verify a universal generalization. After all, the next piece of metal could be such that it does not conduct electricity. In order to verify this hypothesis we would have to investigate all pieces of metal there are—and even if there were only finitely many such pieces, we would never know this (unless there were only finitely many space-time regions we would have to search). Popper’s basic insight is that these universal generalizations can be falsified, though. We only need to find a piece of metal that does not conduct electricity in order to know that our hypothesis is false (supposing we can check this). Popper then generalized this. He suggested that all science should put forth bold hypotheses, which are then severely tested (where ‘bold’ means to have many observational consequences). As long as these hypotheses survive their tests, scientists should stick to them. However, once they are falsified, they should be put aside if there are competing hypotheses that remain unfalsified.

This is not the place to list the numerous problems of Popper’s falsificationism. Suffice it to say that there are many scientific hypotheses that are neither verifiable nor falsifiable, and that falsifying instances are often taken to be indicators of errors that lie elsewhere, say errors of measurement or errors in auxiliary hypotheses. As Duhem and Quine noted, confirmation is holistic in the sense that it is always a whole battery of hypotheses that is put to test, and the arrow of error usually does not point to a single hypothesis (Duhem 1906/1974, Quine 1953).

According to Popper’s falsificationism (see Popper 1935/1994) the hallmark of scientific (rather than meaningful, as in the early days of logical positivism) hypotheses is that they are falsifiable: scientific hypotheses must have consequences whose truth or falsity can in principle (and with a grain of salt) be ascertained by observation (with a grain of salt, because for Popper there is always an element of convention in stipulating the basis of science). If there are no conditions under which a given hypothesis is false, this hypothesis is not scientific (though it may very well be meaningful).

b. Hypothetico-Deductive Confirmation

The hypothetico-deductive notion of confirmation says that an evidential proposition E confirms a hypothesis H relative to background information B if and only if the conjunction of H and B, H ∧ B, logically implies E in some suitable way (which depends on the particular version of hypothetic-deductivism under consideration). The intuition here is that scientific hypotheses are tested; and if a hypothesis H survives a severe test, then, intuitively, this is evidence in favor of H. Furthermore, scientific hypotheses are often used for predictions. If a hypothesis H correctly predicts some experimental outcome E by logically implying it, then, intuitively, this is again evidence for the truth of H. Both of these related aspects are covered by the above definition, if surviving a test is tantamount to entailing the correct outcome.

Note that hypthetico-deductive confirmation—henceforth HD-confirmation—satisfies Hempel’s converse consequence condition. Suppose an evidential proposition E HD-confirms some hypothesis H. This means that H logically implies E in some suitable way. Now any hypothesis H’ which logically implies H also logically implies E. But this means—at least under most conditions fixing the “suitable way” of entailment—that E HD-confirms H’.

Hypothetico-deductivism has run into serious difficulties. To mention just two, there is the problem of irrelevant conjunctions and the problem of irrelevant disjunctions. Suppose an evidential proposition E HD-confirms some hypothesis H. Then, by the converse consequence condition, E also HD-confirms H ∧ H’, for any hypothesis H’ whatsoever. Assuming that the anomalous perihelion of Mercury confirms the general theory of relativity GTR (Earman 1992), it also confirms the conjunction of GTR and, say, that there is life on Mars—which seems to be wrong. Similarly, if E HD-confirms H, then E ∨ E’ HD-confirms H, for any evidential proposition E’ whatsoever. For instance, the disjunctive proposition of the anomalous perihelion of Mercury or the moon’s being made of cheese HD-confirms GTR (Grimes 1990, Moretti 2004).

Another worry with HD-confirmation is that it is not clear how it should be applied to statistical hypotheses that do not entail anything that is not probabilistic, and hence they entail nothing that is observable (see, however, Albert 1992). The treatment of statistical hypotheses is no problem for probabilistic theories of confirmation, which we will turn to now.

4. Inductive Logic

For overview articles see Fitelson (2005) and Hawthorne (2005).

a. Kolmogorov’s Axiomatization

Before we turn to inductive logic, let us define the notion of probability as it was axiomatized by Kolmogorov (1933; 1956).

Let W be a non-empty set (of outcomes or possibilities), and let A be a field over W, that is, a set of subsets of W that contains the whole set W and is closed under complementation (with respect to W) and finite unions. That is, A is a field over W if and only if A is a set of subsets of W such that

(i) W ∈ A

(ii) if A ∈ A, then (W\A) = –A ∈ A

(iii) if A ∈ A and B ∈ A, then (A ∪ B) ∈ A

where “W\A” is the complement of A with respect to W. If (iii) is strengthened to

(iv) if A₁ ∈ A, … A_n ∈ A, …, then (A₁∪…∪A_n∪…) ∈ A,

so that A is closed under countable (and not only finite) unions, A is called a σ-field over W.

A function Pr: A → ℜ from the field A over W into the real numbers ℜ is a (finitely additive) probability measure on A if and only if it is a non-negative, normalized, and (finitely) additive measure; that is, if and only if for all A, B ∈ A

(K1) Pr(A) ≥ 0

(K2) Pr(W) = 1

(K3) if A∩B = ∅, then Pr(A∪ B) = Pr(A) + Pr(B)

The triple <W, A, Pr> with W a non-empty set, A a field over W, and Pr a probability measure on A is called a (finitely additive) probability space. If A is a σ-field over W and Pr: A → ℜ additionally satisfies

(K4) if A₁⊇ A₂⊇ … ⊇ A_n … is a decreasing sequence of elements of A, i.e. A₁ ∈ A, … A_n ∈A, …, such that A₁∩A₂∩…∩A_n∩… = ∅, then lim_n→∞ Pr(A_n) = 0,

Pr is a σ-additive probability measure on A and <W, A, Pr> is a σ-additive probability space (Kolmogorov 1933; 1956, ch. 2). (K4) asserts that

lim_n→∞Pr(A_n) = Pr(A₁∩A₂∩…∩A_n∩…) = Pr(∅) = 0

for a decreasing sequence of elements of A. Given (K1-3), (K4) is equivalent to

(K5) if A₁ ∈ A, … A_n ∈ A, …, and if A_i∩A_j= ∅ for all natural numbers i, j with i ≠ j, then Pr(A₁∪…∪A_n∪…) = Pr(A₁) + … + Pr(A_n) + …

A probability measure Pr: A → ℜ on A is regular just in case Pr(A) > 0 for every non-empty A ∈ A. Let <W, A, Pr> be a probability space, and define A* to be the set of all A ∈ A that have positive probability according to Pr, that is, A* = {A ∈ A: Pr(A) > 0}. The conditional probability measure Pr(•|-): A x A* → ℜ on A (based on the unconditional probability measure Pr) is defined for all A ∈ A and B ∈ A* by the fraction

(K6) Pr(A|B) = Pr(A∩B)/Pr(B)

(Kolmogorov 1933; 1956, ch. 1, §4). The domain of the second argument place of Pr(•|-) has to be restricted to A*, since the fraction Pr(A∩B)/Pr(B) is not defined when Pr(B) = 0. Note that Pr(•|B): A → ℜ is a probability measure on A, for every B ∈ A*.

Here are some immediate consequences of the Kolmogorov axioms and the definition of conditional probability. For every probability space <W, A, Pr> and all A, B ∈ A,

Law of Negation: Pr(-A)= 1 – Pr(A)
Law of Conjunction: Pr(A∩B) = Pr(B)•Pr(A|B) whenever Pr(B) > 0
Law of Disjunction: Pr(A∪B) = Pr(A) + Pr(B) – Pr(A∩B)
Law of Total Probability: Pr(B) = Σ_iPr(B|A_i)•Pr(A_i),

where the A_i form a countable partition of W, i.e. A₁, … A_n, … is a sequence of mutually exclusive (A_i∩A_j= ∅ for all i, j with i ≠ j) and jointly exhaustive (A₁∪…∪A_n∪… = W) elements of A. A special case of the Law of Total Probability is

Pr(B) = Pr(B|A)•Pr(A) + Pr(B|-A)•Pr(-A).

Finally the definition of conditional probability is easily turned into

Bayes’s Theorem: Pr(A|B) = Pr(B|A)•Pr(A)/Pr(B)

= Pr(B|A)•Pr(A)/[Pr(B|A)•Pr(A) + Pr(B|-A)•Pr(-A)]

= Pr(B|A)•Pr(A)/Σ_iPr(B|A_i)•Pr(A_i),

where the A_i form a countable partition of W. The important role played by Bayes’s Theorem (in combination with some principle linking objective chances and subjective probabilities) for confirmation will be discussed below. For more on Bayes’s Theorem see Joyce (2003).

The names of the first three laws above indicate that probability measures can also be defined on formal languages. Instead of defining probability on a field A over some non-empty set W, we can take its domain to be a formal language L, that is, a set of (possibly open) well-formed formulas that contains the tautological sentence τ (corresponding to the whole set W) and is closed under negation ¬ (corresponding to complementation) and disjunction ∨ (corresponding to finite union). That is, L is a language if and only if L is a set of well-formed formulas such that

(i) τ ∈ L

(ii) if α ∈ L, then ¬α ∈ L

(iii) if α ∈ L and β ∈ L, then (α∨ β) ∈ L

If L additionally satisfies

(iv) if α ∈ L, then ∃xα ∈ L,

L is called a quantificational language.

A function Pr: L → ℜ from the language L into the reals ℜ is a probability on L if and only if for all α, β ∈ L,

(L0) Pr(α) = Pr(β) if α is logically equivalent (in the sense of classical logic CL) to β

(L1) Pr(α) ≥ 0,

(L2) Pr(τ) = 1,

(L3) Pr(α∨ β) = Pr(α) + Pr(β), if α∧ β is logically inconsistent (in the sense of CL).

(L0) is not necessary, if (L2) is strengthened to: (L2⁺) Pr(α) = 1, if α is logically valid. If L is a quantificational language with an individual constant “a_i” for each individual a_i in the envisioned countable domain, i = 1, 2, …, n, …, and Pr: L → ℜ additionally satisfies

(L4) lim_n→∞Pr(α[a₁/x]∧…∧α[a_n/x]) = Pr(∀xα),

Pr is called a Gaifman-Snir probability. Here “α[a_i/x]” results from “α[x]” by substituting the individual constant “a_i” for all occurrences of the individual variable “x” in “α.” “x” in “α[x]” indicates that “x” occurs free in “α,” that is to say, “x” is not bound in “α” by a quantifier like it is in “∀xα.”

Given (L0-3) and the restriction to countable domains, (L4) is equivalent to

(L5) lim_n→∞Pr(α[a₁/x]∨…∨α[a_n/x]) = sup{Pr(α[a₁/x]∨…∨α[a_n/x]): n ∈ N} =
Pr(∃xα),

where the equation on the right-hand side is the slightly more general definition adopted by Gaifman & Snir (1982, 501). A probability Pr: L → ℜ on L is regular just in case Pr(α) > 0 for every consistent α ∈ L. For L* = {α ∈ L: Pr(α) > 0} the conditional probability Pr(•|-): L x L* → ℜ on L (based on Pr) is defined for all α ∈ L and all β ∈ L* by the fraction

(L6) Pr(α|β) = Pr(α∧ β)/Pr(β).

As before, Pr(•|β): L → ℜ is a probability on L, for every β ∈ L.

Each probability Pr on a language L induces a probability space <W, A, Pr*> with W being the set Mod of all models for L, A being the smallest σ-field containing the field {Mod(α) ⊆Mod: α ∈ L}, and Pr* being the unique σ-additive probability measure on A such that Pr*(Mod(α)) = Pr(α) for all α ∈ L. (A model for a language L with an individual constant for each individual in the envisioned domain can be represented by a function w: L → {0,1} from L into the set {0,1} such that for all α, β ∈ L: w(¬α) = 1 – w(α), w(α∨β) = max{w(α), w(β)}, and w(∃xα) = max{w(α[a/x]): “a” is an individual constant of L}.)

Some authors take conditional probability Pr(• given -) as primitive and define probability as Pr(• given W) or Pr(• given τ) (see Hájek 2003b). For more on probability and its interpretations see Hájek (2003a), Hájek & Hall (2000), Fitelson & Hájek & Hall (2005).

b. Logical Probability and Degree of Confirmation

There has always been a close connection between probability and induction. Probability was thought to provide the basis for an inductive logic. Early proponents of a logical conception of probability include Keynes (1921/1973) and Jeffreys (1939/1967). However, by far the biggest effort to construct an inductive logic was undertaken by Carnap in his Logical Foundations of Probability (1950/1962). Carnap starts from a simple formal language with countably many individual constants (such as “Carl Gustav Hempel”) denoting individuals (namely, Carl Gustav Hempel) and finitely many monadic predicates (such as “is a great philosopher of science”) denoting properties (namely, being a great philosopher of science), but not relations (such as being a better philosopher of science than). Then he defines a state-description to be a complete description of each individual with respect to all the predicates. For instance, if the language contains three individual constants “a,” “b,” and “c” (denoting the individuals a, b, and c, respectively), and four monadic predicates “P,” “Q,” “R,” and “S” (denoting the properties P, Q, R, and S, respectively), then there are 2^3•4 state descriptions of the form:

±Pa ∧ ±Qa ∧ ±Ra ∧ ±Sa ∧ ±Pb ∧ ±Qb ∧ ±Rb ∧ ±Sb ∧ ±Pc ∧ ±Qc ∧ ±Rc ∧ ±Sc,

where “±” indicates that the predicate in question is either unnegated as in “Pa” or negated as in “¬Pa.” That is, a state description determines for each individual constant “a” and each predicate “P” whether or not Pa. Based on the notion of a state description, Carnap then introduces the notion of a structure description, a maximal disjunction of state descriptions which can be obtained from each other by uniformly substituting individual constants for each other. In the above example there are, among others, the following two structure descriptions:

(Pa ∧ Qa ∧ Ra ∧Sa) ∧ (Pb ∧ Qb ∧ Rb ∧ Sb) ∧ (Pc ∧ Qc ∧ Rc ∧ Sc)

((Pa ∧ Qa∧ Ra ∧ Sa) ∧ (Pb ∧ Qb ∧ Rb ∧ ¬Sb) ∧ (Pc ∧ Qc ∧ ¬Rc ∧ Sc)) ∨((Pb ∧ Qb ∧ Rb ∧ Sb) ∧ (Pa ∧ Qa ∧ Ra ∧ ¬Sa) ∧ (Pc ∧ Qc ∧ ¬Rc ∧ Sc)) ∨((Pc ∧ Qc ∧ Rc ∧ Sc) ∧ (Pb ∧ Qb ∧ Rb ∧ ¬Sb) ∧ (Pa ∧ Qa ∧ ¬Ra ∧ Sa)) ∨((Pa ∧ Qa ∧ Ra ∧ Sa) ∧ (Pc ∧ Qc ∧ Rc ∧ ¬Sc) ∧ (Pb ∧ Qb ∧ ¬Rb ∧ Sb))

So a structure description is a disjunction of one or more state descriptions. It says how many individuals satisfy the maximally consistent predicates (Carnap calls them Q-predicates) that can be formulated in the language. It may, but need not, say which individuals. The first structure description above says that all three individuals a, b, and c have the maximally consistent property Px ∧ Qx ∧ Rx ∧ Sx. The second structure description says that exactly one individual has the maximally consistent property Px ∧ Qx ∧ Rx ∧ Sx, exactly one individual has the maximally consistent property Px ∧ Qx ∧ Rx ∧ ¬Sx, and exactly one individual has the maximally consistent property Px ∧ Qx ∧ ¬Rx ∧ Sx. It does not say which of a, b, and c has the property in question.

Each function that assigns non-negative weights w_i to the state descriptions z_i whose sum Σ_iw_i equals 1 induces a probability on the language in question. Carnap then argues—by postulating various principles of symmetry and invariance—that each of the finitely many structure (not state) descriptions s_j should be assigned the same weight v_j such that their sum Σ_jv_j is equal to 1. This weight v_j should then be divided equally among the state descriptions whose disjunction constitutes the structure description s_j. The probability so obtained is Carnap’s favorite m^*, which, like any other probability, induces what Carnap calls a confirmation function (and what we have called a conditional probability): c^*(H, E) = m^*(H ∧ E)/m^*(E)

(In case the language contains countably infinitely many individual constants, some structure descriptions are disjunctions of infinitely many state descriptions. These state descriptions cannot all get the same positive weight. Therefore Carnap considers the limit of the measures m^*_nfor the languages L_n containing the first n individual constants in some enumeration of the individual constants, provided this limit exists.)

c^* allows learning from experience in the sense that

c^*(the n + 1st individual is P, k of the first n individuals are P) > c^*(the n + 1st individual is P, τ)

= m^*(the n + 1st individual is P),

where τ is the tautological sentence. If we assigned equal weights to the state descriptions instead of the structure descriptions, no such learning would be possible. Let us check that c^*allows learning from experience for n = 2 in a language with three individual constants “a,” “b,” and “c” and one predicate “P.” There are eight state descriptions and four structure descriptions:

z₁ = Pa ∧ Pb ∧ Pc s₁ = Pa ∧ Pb ∧ Pc:

z₂ = Pa ∧ Pb ∧ ¬Pc All three individuals are P.

z₃ = Pa ∧ ¬Pb ∧ Pc s₂ = (Pa ∧ Pb ∧ ¬Pc)∨(Pa ∧ ¬Pb ∧ Pc)∨(¬Pa ∧ Pb ∧ Pc):

z₄ = Pa ∧ ¬Pb ∧ ¬Pc Exactly two individuals are P.

z₅ = ¬Pa ∧ Pb ∧ Pc s₃ = (Pa ∧ ¬Pb ∧ ¬Pc)∨(¬Pa ∧ Pb ∧ ¬Pc)∨(¬Pa ∧ ¬Pb ∧ Pc):

z₆ = ¬Pa ∧ Pb ∧ ¬Pc Exactly one individual is P.

z₇ = ¬Pa ∧ ¬Pb ∧ Pc s₄ = ¬Pa ∧ ¬Pb ∧ ¬Pc:

z₈ = ¬Pa ∧ ¬Pb ∧ ¬Pc None of the three individuals is P.

Each structure description s₁–s₄ gets weight v_j = 1/4 (j = 1, …, 4).

s₁ = z₁: v₁ = m^*(Pa ∧ Pb ∧ Pc) = 1/4

s₂ = z₂∨z₃∨z₅: v₂ = m^*((Pa ∧ Pb ∧ ¬Pc)∨(Pa ∧ ¬Pb ∧ Pc)∨(¬Pa ∧ Pb ∧ Pc)) = 1/4

s₃ = z₄∨z₆∨z₇: v₃ = m^*((Pa ∧ ¬Pb ∧ ¬Pc)∨(¬Pa ∧ Pb ∧ ¬Pc)∨(¬Pa ∧ ¬Pb ∧ Pc)) = 1/4

s₄ = z₈: v₄ = m^*(¬Pa ∧ ¬Pb ∧ ¬Pc) = 1/4

These weights are equally divided among the state descriptions z₁–z₈.

z₁: w₁ = m^*(Pa ∧ Pb ∧ Pc) = 1/4 z₅: w₅ = m^*(¬Pa ∧ Pb∧ Pc) = 1/12

z₂: w₂ = m^*(Pa ∧ Pb ∧ ¬Pc) = 1/12 z₆: w₆ = m^*(¬Pa ∧ Pb ∧ ¬Pc) = 1/12

z₃: w₃ = m^*(Pa ∧ ¬Pb ∧ Pc) = 1/12 z₇: w₇ = m^*(¬Pa ∧ ¬Pb ∧ Pc) = 1/12

z₄: w₄ = m^*(Pa ∧ ¬Pb ∧ ¬Pc) = 1/12 z₈: w₈ = m^*(¬Pa ∧ ¬Pb ∧ ¬Pc) = 1/4

Let us now compute the values of the confirmation function c^*.

c^*(the 3^rd individual is P, 2 of the first 2 individuals are P) =

= m^*(the 3^rd individual is P, the first 2 individuals are P)/m^*(the first 2 individuals are P)

= m^*(the first 3 individuals are P)/m^*(the first 2 individuals are P)

= m^*(Pa ∧ Pb ∧ Pc)/m^*(Pa ∧ Pb)

= (1/4)/(1/4 + 1/12)

= 3/4

> 1/2 = m^*(Pc) = c* (the 3^rd individual is P)

The general formula is (Carnap 1950/1962, 568)

c^*(the n + 1st individual is P, k of the first n individuals are P)

= (k + ϖ)/(n + κ)

= (k + (ϖ/κ)•κ)/(n + κ),

where ϖ is the “logical width” of the predicate “P” (Carnap 1950/1962, 127), that is, the number of maximally consistent properties or Q-predicates whose disjunction is logically equivalent to “P” (ϖ = 1 in our example: “P”). κ = 2^π is the total number of Q-predicates (κ = 2¹ = 2 in our example: “P” and “¬P”) with π being the number of primitive predicates (π = 1 in our example: “P”). This formula is dependent on the logical factor ϖ/κ of the “relative width” of the predicate “P,” and the empirical factor k/n of the relative frequency of Ps.

Later on, Carnap (1952) generalizes this to a whole continuum of confirmation functions C_λ where the parameter λ is inversely proportional to the impact of evidence. λ specifies how the confirmation function C_λ weighs between the logical factor ϖ/κ and the empirical factor k/n. For λ = ∞, C_λ is independent of the empirical factor k/n: C_λ(the n + 1st individual is P, k of the first n individuals are P) = ϖ/κ (Carnap 1952, §13). For λ = 0, C_λ is independent of the logical factor ϖ/κ: C_λ(the n + 1st individual is P, k of the first n individuals are P) = k/n and thus coincides with what is known as the straight rule (Carnap 1952, §14). c^*is the special case with λ = κ (Carnap 1952, §15). The general formula is (Carnap 1952, §9)

C_λ(the n + 1st individual is P, k of the first n individuals are P) = (k + λ/κ)/(n + λ).

In his (1963) Carnap slightly modifies the set up and considers families of monadic predicates {“P₁,” …, “P_p“} like the family of color predicates {“red,” “green,” …, “blue”}. For a given family {“P₁,” …, “P_p“} and each individual constant “a” there is exactly one predicate “P_j” such that P_ja. Families thus generalize {“P,” “¬P“} and correspond to random variables. Given his axioms (including A15), Carnap (1963, 976) can show that for each family {“P₁,” …, “P_p“}, p ≥ 2,

C_λ(the n + 1st individual is P_j, k of the first n individuals are P_j) = (k + λ/p)/(n + λ).

One of the peculiar features of Carnap’s systems is that universal generalizations get degree of confirmation (alias conditional probability) 0. Hintikka (1966) generalizes Carnap’s project in this respect. For a neo-Carnapian approach see Maher (2004a).

Of more interest to us is Carnap’s discussion of “the controversial problem of the justification of induction” (1963, 978, emphasis in the original). For Carnap, the justification of induction boils down to justifying the axioms specifying a set of confirmation functions. The “reasons are based upon our intuitive judgments concerning inductive validity”. Therefore “[i]t is impossible to give a purely deductive justification of induction,” and these “reasons are a priori” (Carnap 1963, 978). So according to Carnap, induction is justified by appeals to intuition about inductive validity. We will see below that Goodman, who is otherwise very skeptical about the prospects of Carnap’s project, shares this view of the justification of induction. The view also seems to be widely accepted among current Bayesian confirmation theorists and their desideratum/explicatum approach (see Fitelson 2001 for an example). [According to Carnap (1962), an explication is “the transformation of an inexact, prescientific concept, the explicandum, into a new exact concept, the explicatum.” (Carnap 1962, 3) The desideratum/explicatum approach consists in stating various “intuitively plausible desiderata” the explicatum is supposed to satisfy. Proposals for explicata that do not satisfy these desiderata are rejected. This appeal to intuitions is fine as long as we are engaging in conceptual analysis. However, contemporary confirmation theorists also sell their accounts as normative theories. Normative theories are not justified by appeal to intuitions. They are justified relative to a goal by showing that the norms in question further the goal at issue. See section 7.]

First, however, we will have a look at what Carnap has to say about Hempel’s conditions of adequacy.

c. Absolute and Incremental Confirmation

As we saw in the preceding section, one of Carnap’s goals was to define a quantitative notion of confirmation, explicated by a confirmation function in the manner indicated above. It is important to note that this quantitative concept of confirmation is a relation between two propositions H and E (three, if we include the background information B), a number r, and a confirmation function c. In chapters VI and VII of his (1950/1962) Carnap discusses comparative and qualitative concepts of confirmation. The explicans for qualitative confirmation he offers is that of positive probabilistic relevance in the sense of some logical probability m. That is, E qualitatively confirms H in the sense of some logical measure m just in case E is positively relevant to H in the sense of m, that is,

m(H∧ E) > m(H)•m(E).

If both m(H) and m(E) are positive—which is the case whenever both H and E are not logically false, because Carnap assumes m to be regular—this is equivalently expressed by the following inequality:

c(H, E) > c(H, τ) = m(H)

So provided both H and E have positive probability, E confirms H if and only if E raises the conditional probability (degree of confirmation in the sense of c) of H. Let us call this concept incremental confirmation. Again, note that qualitative confirmation is a relation between two propositions H and E, and a conditional probability or confirmation function c. Incremental confirmation, or positive probabilistic relevance, is a qualitative notion. It says whether E raises the conditional probability (degree of confirmation in the sense of c) of H. Its natural quantitative counterpart measures how much E raises the conditional probability of H. This measure may take several forms which will be discussed below.

Incremental confirmation is different from the concept of absolute confirmation on which it is based. The quantitative explication of absolute confirmation is given by one of Carnap’s confirmation functions c. The qualitative counterpart is to say that E absolutely confirms H in the sense of c if and only if the degree of absolute confirmation of H by E is sufficiently high, c(H, E) > r. So Carnap, who offers degree of absolute confirmation c(H, E) as explication for the quantitative notion of confirmation of H by E, and who offers incremental confirmation or positive probabilistic relevance between E and H as explication of the qualitative notion of confirmation, is, to say the least, not fully consistent in his terminology. He switches between absolute confirmation (for the quantitative notion) and incremental confirmation (for the qualitative notion). This is particularly peculiar, because Carnap (1950/1962, §87) is the locus classicus for the discussion of Hempel’s conditions of adequacy mentioned in section 2b.

d. Carnap’s Analysis of Hempel’s Conditions

In analyzing the special consequence condition, Carnap argues that

Hempel has in mind as explicandum the following relation: “the degree of confirmation of H by E is greater than r, where r is a fixed value, perhaps 0 or 1/2 (Carnap 1962, 475; notation adapted);

that is, the qualitative concept of absolute confirmation. Similarly when discussing the special consistency condition:

Hempel regards it as a great advantage of any explicatum satisfying [a more general form of the special consistency condition 3] “that it sets a limit, so to speak, to the strength of the hypotheses which can be confirmed by given evidence” … This argument does not seem to have any plausibility for our explicandum, (Carnap 1962, 477; emphasis in original)

which is the qualitative concept of incremental confirmation,

[b]ut it is plausible for the second explicandum mentioned earlier: the degree of [absolute] confirmation exceeding a fixed value r. Therefore we may perhaps assume that Hempel’s acceptance of [a more general form of 3] is due again to an inadvertent shift to the second explicandum. (Carnap 1962, 477-478)

Carnap’s analysis can be summarized as follows. In presenting his first three conditions of adequacy, Hempel was mixing up two distinct concepts of confirmation, two distinct explicanda in Carnap’s terminology, namely,

(i) the qualitative concept of incremental confirmation (positive probabilistic relevance) according to which E confirms H if and only if E (has non-zero probability and) increases the degree of absolute confirmation (conditional probability) of H, and

(ii) the qualitative concept of absolute confirmation according to which E confirms H if and only if the degree of absolute confirmation (conditional probability) of H by E is greater than some value r.

Hempel’s second and third condition, 2 and 3, respectively, hold true for the second explicandum (for r ≥ 1/2), but they do not hold true for the first explicandum. On the other hand, Hempel’s first condition holds true for the first explicandum, but it does so only in a qualified form (Carnap 1950/1962, 473)—namely only if E is not assigned probability 0, and H is not already assigned probability 1.

This, however, means that, according to Carnap’s analysis, Hempel first had in mind the explicandum of incremental confirmation for the entailment condition. Then he had in mind the explicandum of absolute confirmation for the special consequence and the special consistency conditions 2 and 3, respectively. And then, when Hempel presented the converse consequence condition, he got completely confused and had in mind still another explicandum or concept of confirmation (neither the first nor the second explicandum satisfies the converse consequence condition). This is not a very charitable analysis. It is not a good one either, because the qualitative concept of absolute confirmation, which Hempel is said to have had in mind for 2 and 3, also satisfies 1—and it does so without the second qualification that H be assigned a probability smaller than 1. So there is no need to accuse Hempel of mixing up two concepts of confirmation. Indeed, the analysis is bad, because Carnap’s reading of Hempel also leaves open the question of what the third explicandum for the converse consequence condition might have been. For a different analysis of Hempel’s conditions and a corresponding logic of confirmation see Huber (2007a).

5. The New Riddle of Induction and the Demise of the Syntactic Approach

According to Goodman (1983, ch. III), the problem of justifying induction boils down to defining valid inductive rules, and thus to a definition of confirmation. The reason is that an inductive inference is justified by conformity to an inductive rule, and inductive rules are justified by their conformity to accepted inductive practices. One does not have to follow Goodman in this respect, however, in order to appreciate his insight that whether a hypothesis is confirmed by a piece of evidence depends on features other than their syntactical form.

In his (1946) he asks us to suppose a marble has been drawn from a certain bowl on each of the ninety-nine days up to and including VE day, and that each marble drawn was red. Our evidence can be described by the conjunction “Marble 1 is red and … and marble 99 is red,” in symbols: Ra₁∧ …∧ Ra₉₉. Whatever the details of our theory of confirmation, this evidence will confirm the hypothesis “Marble 100 is red,” R₁₀₀. Now consider the predicate S = “is drawn by VE day and is red, or is drawn after VE day and is not red.” In terms of S rather than R our evidence is described by the conjunction “Marble 1 is drawn by VE day and is red or it is drawn after VE day and is not red, and …, and marble 99 is drawn by VE day and is red or it is drawn after VE day and is not red,” Sa₁∧ …∧ Sa₉₉. If our theory of confirmation relies solely on syntactical features of the evidence and the hypothesis, our evidence will confirm the conclusion “Marble 100 is drawn by VE and is red, or it is drawn after VE day and is not red,” S₁₀₀. But we know that the next marble will be drawn after VE day. Given this, S₁₀₀ is logically equivalent to the negation of R₁₀₀. So one and the same piece of evidence can be used to confirm a hypothesis and its negation, which is certainly absurd.

One might object to this example that the two formulations do not describe one and the same piece of evidence after all. The first formulation in terms of R should be the conjunction “Marble 1 is drawn by VE day and is red, and …, and marble 99 is drawn by VE day and is red,” (Da₁∧ Ra₁)∧ …∧ (Da₉₉∧ Ra₉₉). The second formulation in terms of S should be “Marble 1 is drawn by VE day and it is drawn by VE day and red or drawn after VE and not red, and …, and marble 99 is drawn by VE day and it is drawn by VE day and red or drawn after VE day and not red,” (Da₁∧ Sa₁)∧ …∧ (Da₉₉∧ Sa₉₉). Now the two formulations really describe one and the same piece of evidence in the sense of being logically equivalent. But then the problem is whether any interesting statement can ever be confirmed. The syntactical form of the evidence now seems to confirm Da₁₀₀∧ Ra₁₀₀, equivalently Da₁₀₀∧ Sa₁₀₀. But we know that the next marble is drawn after VE day; that is, we know ¬Da₁₀₀. That the future resembles the past in all respects is thus false. That it resembles the past in some respects is trivial. The new riddle of induction is the question in which respects the future resembles the past, and in which it does not.

It has been suggested that the puzzling character of Goodman’s example is due to its mentioning a particular point of time, namely, VE day. A related reaction has been that gerrymandered predicates, whether or not they involve a particular point of time, cannot be used in inductive inferences. But there are plenty of similar examples (Stalker 1994), and it is commonly agreed that Goodman has succeeded in showing that a purely syntactical definition of (degree of) confirmation won’t do. Goodman himself sought to solve his new riddle of induction by distinguishing between “projectible” predicates such as “red” and unprojectible predicates such as “is drawn by VE day and is red, or is drawn after VE day and is not red.” The projectibility of a predicate is in turn determined by its entrenchment in natural language. This comes very close to saying that the projectible predicates are the ones that we do in fact project (that is, use in inductive inferences). (Quine’s 1969 “natural kinds” are special cases of what can be described by projectible predicates.)

6. Bayesian Confirmation Theory

Bayesian confirmation theory is by far the most popular and elaborated theory of confirmation. It has its origins in Rudolf Carnap’s work on inductive logic (Carnap 1950/1962), but relieves itself from defining confirmation in terms of logical probability. More or less any subjective degree of belief function satisfying the Kolmogorov axioms is considered to be an admissible probability measure.

a. Subjective Probability and the Dutch Book Argument

In Bayesian confirmation theory, a probability measure on a field of propositions is usually interpreted as an agent’s degree of belief function. There is disagreement about how broad the class of admissible probability measures is to be construed. Some objective Bayesians such as the early Carnap insist that the class consist of a single logical probability measure, whereas subjective Bayesians admit any probability measure. Most Bayesians will be somewhere in the middle of this spectrum when it comes to the question which particular degree of belief functions it is reasonable to adopt in a particular situation. However, they will agree that from a purely logical point of view any (regular) probability measure is acceptable. The standard argument for this position is the Dutch Book Argument.

The Dutch Book Argument starts with the assumption that there is a link between subjective degrees of belief and betting ratios. It is further assumed that it is pragmatically defective to accept a series of bets which guarantees a sure loss, that is, a Dutch Book. By appealing to the Dutch Book Theorem that an agent’s betting ratios satisfy the probability axioms just in case they do not make the agent vulnerable to such a Dutch Book, it is inferred that it is epistemically defective to have degrees of belief that violate the probability axioms. The strength of this inference is, of course, dependent on the link between degrees of belief and betting ratios. If this link is identity—as it is when one defines degrees of belief as betting ratios—the distinction between pragmatic and epistemic defectiveness disappears, and the Dutch Book Argument is a deductively valid argument. But this comes at the cost of rendering the link between degrees of belief and betting ratios implausible. If the link is weaker than identity—as it is when degrees of belief are only measured by betting ratios—the Dutch Book Argument is not deductively valid anymore, but it has more plausible assumptions.

The pragmatic nature of the Dutch Book Argument has led to so called depragmatized versions. A depragmatized Dutch Book Argument starts with a link between degrees of belief and fair betting ratios, and it assumes that it is epistemically defective to consider a series of bets that guarantees a sure loss as fair. Using the depragmatized Dutch Book Theorem that an agent’s fair betting ratios obey the probability calculus if and only if the agent never considers a Dutch Book as fair, it is then inferred that it is epistemically defective to have degrees of belief that do not obey the probability calculus. The thesis that an agent’s degree of belief function should obey the probability calculus is called probabilism. For more on the Dutch Book Argument see Hájek (2005) and Vineberg (2005). For a different justification of probabilism in terms of the accuracy of degrees of belief see Joyce (1998).

b. Confirmation Measures

Let A be a field of propositions over some set of possibilities W, let H, E, B be propositions from A, and let Pr be a probability measure on A. We already know that H is incrementally confirmed by E relative to B in the sense of Pr if and only if Pr(H∩E|B) > Pr(H|B)•Pr(E|B), and that this is a relation between three propositions and a probability space whose field contains the propositions. The central notion in Bayesian confirmation theory is that of a confirmation measure. A real valued function c: P → ℜ from the set P of all probability spaces <W, A, Pr> into the reals ℜ is a confirmation measure if and only if for every probability space <W, A, Pr> and all H, E, B ∈ A:

c(H, E, B) > 0 ↔ Pr(H∩E|B) > Pr(H|B)•Pr(E|B)

c(H, E, B) = 0 ↔ Pr(H∩E|B) = Pr(H|B)•Pr(E|B)

c(H, E, B) < 0 ↔ Pr(H∩E|B) < Pr(H|B)•Pr(E|B)

The six most popular confirmation measures are (what I now call) the Carnap measure c (Carnap 1962), the distance measure d (Earman 1992), the log-likelihood or Good-Fitelson measure l (Fitelson 1999 and Good 1983), the log-ratio or Milne measure r (Milne 1996), the Joyce-Christensen measure s (Christensen 1999, Joyce 1999, ch. 6), and the relative distance measure z (Crupi & Tentori & Gonzalez 2007).

c(H, E, B) = Pr(H∩E|B) – Pr(H|B)•Pr(E|B)

d(H, E, B) = Pr(H|E∩B) – Pr(H|B)

l(H, E, B) = log [Pr(E|H∩B)/Pr(E|-H∩B)]

r(H, E, B) = log [Pr(H|E∩B)/Pr(H|B)]

s(H, E, B) = Pr(H|E∩B) – Pr(H|-E∩B)

z(H, E, B) = [Pr(H|E∩B) – Pr(H|B)]/Pr(-H|B) if Pr(H|E∩B) ≥Pr(H|B)

= [Pr(H|E∩B) – Pr(H|B)]/Pr(H|B) if Pr(H|E∩B) < Pr(H|B)

(Mathematically speaking, there are uncountably many confirmation measures.) For an overview article, see Eells (2005). Book length expositions are Earman (1992) and Howson & Urbach (1989/2005).

c. Some Success Stories

Bayesian confirmation theory captures the insights of Popper’s falsificationism and hypothetico-deductive confirmation. Suppose evidence E falsifies hypothesis H relative to background information B in the sense that B∩H∩E = ∅. Then Pr(E∩H|B) = 0, and so Pr(E∩H|B) = 0 < Pr(H|B)•Pr(E|B), provided both Pr(H|B) and Pr(E|B) are positive. So as long as H is not already known to be false (in the sense of having probability 0 conditional on B) and E is a possible outcome (one with positive probability conditional on B), falsifying E incrementally disconfirms H relative to B in the sense of Pr.

Remember, E HD-confirms H relative to B if and only if the conjunction of H and B logically implies E (in some suitable way). In this case Pr(E∩H|B) = Pr(H|B), provided Pr(B) > 0. Hence as long as Pr(E|B) < 1, we have

Pr(E∩H|B) > Pr(H|B)•Pr(E|B),

which means that E incrementally confirms H relative to B in the sense of Pr (Kuipers 2000).

If the conjunction of H and B logically implies E, but E is already known to be true in the sense of having probability 1 conditional on B, E does not incrementally confirm H relative to B in the sense of Pr. In fact, no E which receives probability 1 conditional on B can incrementally confirm any H whatsoever. This is the so called problem of old evidence (Glymour 1980). It is a special case of a more general phenomenon. The following is true for many confirmation measures (d, l, and r, but not s). If H is positively relevant to E given B, the degree to which E incrementally confirms H relative to B is greater, the smaller the probability of E given B. Similarly, if H is negatively relevant for E given B, the degree to which E disconfirms H relative to B is greater, the smaller the probability of E given B (Huber 2005a). If Pr(E|B) = 1 we have the problem of old evidence. If Pr(E|B) = 0 we have the above mentioned problem that E cannot disconfirm hypotheses it falsifies.

Some people simply deny that the problem of old evidence is a problem. Bayesian confirmation theory, it is said, does not explicate whether and how much E confirms H relative to B. It explicates whether E is additional evidence for H relative to B, and how much additional confirmation E provides for H relative to B. If E already has probability 1 conditional on B, it is part of the background knowledge, and so does not provide any additional evidence for H. More generally, the more we already believe in E, the less additional (dis)confirmation this provides for positively (negatively) relevant H. This reply does not work in case E is a falsifier of H with probability 0 conditional on B, for in this case Pr(H|E∩B) is not defined. It also does not agree with the fact that the problem of old evidence is taken seriously in the literature on Bayesian confirmation theory (Earman 1992, ch. 5). An alternative view (Joyce 1999, ch. 6) sees several different, but equally legitimate, concepts of confirmation at work. The intuition behind one concept is the reason for the implausibility of the explication of another.

In contrast to hypothetico-deductivism, Bayesian confirmation theory has no problem with assigning degrees of incremental confirmation to statistical hypotheses. Such alternative statistical hypotheses H₁, …H_n, … are taken to specify the probability of an outcome E. The probabilities Pr(E|H₁), …Pr(E|H_n), … are called the likelihoods of the hypotheses H_i. Together with their prior probabilities Pr(H_i) the likelihoods determine the posterior probabilities of the H_i via Bayes’s Theorem:

Pr(H_i|E) = Pr(E|H_i)•Pr(H_i)/[Σ_jPr(E|H_j)•Pr(H_j) + Pr(E|H)•Pr(H)]

The so called “catchall” hypothesis H is the negation of the disjunction or union of all the alternative hypotheses H_i, and so it is equivalent to -(H₁∪…∪H_n∪…). It is important to note the implicit use of something like the principal principle (Lewis 1980) in such an application of Bayes’ Theorem. The probability measure Pr figuring in the above equation is an agent’s degree of belief function. The statistical hypotheses H_i specify the objective chance of the outcome E as Ch_i(E). Without a principle linking objective chances to subjective degrees of belief, nothing guarantees that the agent’s conditional degree of belief in E given H_i, Pr(E|H_i), is equal to the chance of E as specified by H_i, Ch_i(E). The principal principle says that an agent’s conditional degree of belief in a proposition A given the information that the chance of A is equal to r (and no further inadmissible information) should be r, Pr(A|Ch(A) = r) = r. For more on the principal principle see Hall (1994), Lewis (1994), Thau (1994), as well as Briggs (2009a). Spohn (2010) shows that the principal principle is a special case of the reflection principle (van Fraassen 1984; 1995, Briggs 2009b). The latter principle says that an agent’s current conditional degree of belief in A given that her future degree of belief in A equals r should be r,

Pr_now(A|Pr_later(A) = r) = r provided Pr_now(Pr_later(A)=r) > 0.

Bayesian confirmation theory can also handle the ravens paradox. As we have seen, Hempel thought that “a is neither black nor a raven” confirms “All ravens are black” relative to no or tautological background information. He attributed the unintuitive character of this claim to a conflation of it and the claim that “a is neither black nor a raven” confirms “All ravens are black” relative to our actual background knowledge A—and the fact that A contains the information that there are more non-black objects than ravens. The latter information is reflected in our degree of belief function Pr by the inequality

Pr(¬Ba|A) > Pr(Ra|A).

If we further assume that the probabilities of finding a non-black object as well as finding a raven are independent of whether or not all ravens are black,

Pr(¬Ba|∀x(Rx → Bx)∧A) = Pr(¬Ba|A),

Pr(Ra|∀x(Rx → Bx)∧A) = Pr(Ra|A),

we can infer (when we assume all probabilities to be defined) that

Pr(∀x(Rx → Bx)|Ra∧Ba∧A) > Pr(∀x(Rx → Bx)|¬Ra∧¬Ba∧A) >
Pr(∀x(Rx → Bx)|A).

So Hempel’s intuitions are vindicated by Bayesian confirmation theory to the extent that the above independence assumptions are plausible (or there are weaker assumptions entailing a similar result), and to the extent that he also took non-black non-ravens to confirm the ravens hypothesis relative to our actual background knowledge. For more, see Vranas (2004).

Let us finally consider the problem of irrelevant conjunction in Bayesian confirmation theory. HD-confirmation satisfies the converse consequence condition, and so has the undesirable feature that E confirms H∧H’ relative to B whenever E confirms H relative to B, for any H’ whatsoever. This is not true for incremental confirmation. Even if Pr(E∧H|B) > Pr(E|B)•Pr(H|B), it need not be the case that Pr(E∧H∧H’|B) > Pr(E|B)•Pr(H∧H’|B). However, the following special case is also true for incremental confirmation.

If H∧B logically implies E, then E incrementally confirms H∧H’ relative to B, for any H’ whatsoever (whenever the relevant probabilities are defined).

In the spirit of the last paragraph, one can, however, show that H∧H’ is less confirmed by E relative to B than H alone (in the sense of the distance measure d and the Good-Fitelson measure l) if H’ is an irrelevant conjunct to H given B with respect to E in the sense that

Pr(E|H∧H’∧B) = Pr(E|H∧B)

(Hawthorne & Fitelson 2004). If H∧B logically implies E, then every H’ such that Pr(H∧H’∧B) > 0 is irrelevant in this sense. For more see Fitelson (2002), Hawthorne & Fitelson (2004), Maher (2004b).

7. Taking Stock

Let us grant that Bayesian confirmation theory adequately explicates the concept of confirmation. If so, then this is the concept scientists use when they say that the anomalous perihelion of Mercury confirms the general theory of relativity. It is also the concept more ordinary epistemic agents use when they say that, relative to what they have experienced so far, the dark clouds on the sky are evidence that it will rain soon. The question remains what happened to Hume’s problem of the justification of induction. We know—by definition—that the conclusion of an inductively strong argument is well-confirmed by its premises. But does that also justify our acceptance of that conclusion? Don’t we first have to justify our definition of confirmation before we can use it to justify our inductive inferences?

It seems we would have to, but, as Hume argued, such a justification of induction is not possible. All we could hope for is an adequate description of our inductive practices. As we have seen, Goodman took the task of adequately describing induction as being tantamount to its justification (Goodman 1983, ch. III, ascribes a similar view to Hume, which is somehow peculiar, because Hume argued that a justification of induction is impossible). In doing so he appealed to deductive logic, which he claimed to be justified by its conformity to accepted practices of deductive reasoning. But that is not so. Deductive logic is not justified because it adequately describes our practices of deductive reasoning—it doesn’t. The rules of deductive logic are justified relative to the goal of truth preservation in all possible worlds. The reasons are that (i) in going from the premises of a deductively valid argument to its conclusion, truth is preserved in all possible worlds (this is known as soundness); and that (ii) any argument with that property is a deductively valid argument (this is known as completeness). Similarly for the rules of nonmonotonic logic, which are justified relative to the goal of truth preservation in all “normal” worlds (for normality see e.g. Koons 2005). The reason is that all and only nonmonotonically valid inferences are such that truth is preserved in all normal worlds when one jumps from the premises to the conclusion (Kraus & Lehmann & Magidor 1990, for a survey see Makinson 1994). More generally, the justification of a canon of normative principles—such as the rules of deductive logic, the rules of nonmonotonic logic, or the rules of inductive logic—are only justified relative to a certain goal when one can show that adhering to these normative principles in some sense furthers the goal in question.

Much like Goodman, Carnap sought to justify the principles of his inductive logic by appeals to intuition (cf. the quote in section 4b). Contemporary Bayesian confirmation theorists with their desideratum/explicatum approach follow Carnap and Goodman at least insofar as they apparently do not see the need for justifying their accounts of confirmation by more than appeals to intuition. These are supposed to show that their definitions of confirmation are adequate. But the alleged impossibility of justifying induction does not entail that its adequate description or explication in form of a particular theory of confirmation is sufficient to justify inductive inferences based on that theory. Moreover, as noted by Reichenbach (1938; 1940), a justification of induction is not impossible after all. Hume was right in claiming that there is no deductively valid argument with knowable premises and the conclusion that inductively strong arguments lead from true premises to true conclusions. But this is not the only conclusion that would justify induction. Reichenbach was mainly interested in the limiting relative frequencies of particular types of events in various sequences of events. He could show that a particular inductive rule—the straight rule that conjectures that the limiting relative frequency is equal to the observed relative frequency—will converge to the true limiting relative frequency, if any inductive rule does. However, the straight rule is not the only rule with this property. Therefore its justification relative to the goal of converging to limiting relative frequencies is at least incomplete. If we want to keep the analogy to deductive logic, we can put things as follows: Reichenbach was able to establish the soundness, but not the completeness, of his inductive logic (that is, the straight rule) with respect to the goal of converging to the true limiting relative frequency. (Reichenbach himself provides an example that proves the incompleteness of the straight rule with respect to this goal.)

While soundness in this sense is not sufficient for a justification of the straight rule, such results provide more reasons than appeals to intuition. They are necessary conditions for the justification of a normative rule of inference relative to a particular goal of inquiry. A similar view about the justification of induction is held by formal learning theory. Here one considers the objective reliability with which a particular method (such as the straight rule or a particular confirmation measure) finds out the correct answer to a given question. The use of a method to answer a question is only justified when the method reliably answers the question, if any method does. As different questions differ in their complexity, there are different senses of reliability. A method may correctly answer a question after finitely many steps and with a sign that the question is answered correctly—as when we answer the question whether the first observed raven is black by saying “yes” if it is, and “no” otherwise. Or it may answer the question after finitely many steps and with a sign that it has done so when the answer is “yes,” but not when the answer is “no”—as when we answer the question whether there exists a black raven by saying “yes” when we first observe a black raven, and by saying “no” otherwise. Or it may stabilize to the correct answer in the sense that the method conjectures the right answer after finitely many steps and continues to do so forever without necessarily giving a sign that it has arrived at the correct answer—as when we answer the question whether the limiting relative frequency of black ravens among all ravens is greater than .5 by saying “yes” as long as the observed relative frequency is greater than .5, and by saying “no” otherwise (under the assumption that this limit exists). And so on. This provides a classification of all problems in terms of their complexity. The use of a particular method for answering a question of a certain complexity is only justified if the method reliably answers the question in the sense of reliability determined by the complexity of the question. A discussion of Bayesian confirmation theory from the point of view of formal learning theory can be found in Kelly & Glymour (2004). Schulte (2002) gives an introduction to the main philosophical ideas of formal learning theory. A technically advanced book length exposition is Kelly (1996). The general idea is the same as before. A rule is justified relative to a certain goal to the extent that the rule furthers achieving the goal.

So can we justify particular inductive rules in the form of confirmation measures along these lines? We had better, for otherwise there might be inductive rules that would reliably lead us to the correct answer about a question where our inductive rules won’t (cf. Putnam 1963a; see also his 1963b). Before answering this question, let us first be clear which goal confirmation is supposed to further. In other words, why should we accept well-confirmed hypotheses rather than any other hypotheses? A natural answer is that science and our more ordinary epistemic enterprises aim at true hypotheses. The justification for confirmation would then be that we should accept well-confirmed hypotheses, because we are in some sense guaranteed to arrive at true hypotheses if (and only if) we stick to well-confirmed hypotheses. Something along these lines is true for absolute confirmation according to which degree of confirmation is equal to probability conditional on the data. More precisely, the Gaifman and Snir convergence theorem (Gaifman & Snir 1982) says that for almost every world or model w for the underlying language—that is, all worlds w except, possibly, for those in a set of measure 0 (in the sense of the measure Pr* on the σ-field A from section 4a)—the probability of a hypothesis conditional on the first n data sentences from w converges to its truth value in w (1 for true, 0 for false). It is assumed here that the set of all data sentences separates the set of all worlds (in the sense that for any two distinct worlds there is a data sentence which is true in the one and false in the other world). If we accept a hypothesis as true as soon as its probability is greater than .5 (or any other positive threshold value < 1), and reject it as false otherwise, we are guaranteed to almost surely arrive at true hypotheses after finitely many steps. That does not mean that no other method can do equally well. But it is more than to simply appeal to our intuitions, and a necessary condition for the justification of absolute confirmation relative to the goal of truth. See also Earman (1992, ch. 9) and Juhl (1997).

A more limited result is true for incremental confirmation. Based on the Gaifman and Snir convergence theorem one can show for every confirmation measure c and almost all worlds w that there is an n such that for all later m: the conjunction of the first m data sentences confirms hypotheses that are true in w to a non-negative degree, and it confirms hypotheses that are false in w to a non-positive degree (the set of all data sentences is again assumed to separate the set of all worlds). Even if this more limited result were a satisfying justification for the claim that incremental confirmation furthers the goal of truth, the question remains why one has to go to incremental confirmation in order to arrive at true theories. It also remains unclear what degrees of incremental confirmation are supposed to indicate, for it is completely irrelevant for the above result whether a positive degree of confirmation is high or low—all that matters is that it is positive. This is in contrast to absolute confirmation. There a high number represents a high probability—that is, a high probability of being true—which almost surely converges to the truth value itself. To make these vague remarks more vivid, let us consider an example.

Suppose I know I get a bottle of wine for my birthday, and I am curious as to whether it is a bottle or red wine, A, white wine, B, or rosé, C. It is common knowledge that I like red wine, and so my initial degree of belief function Pr is such that

Pr(A) = .9, Pr(B) = Pr(C) = .05, Pr(A∧B) = Pr(A∧C) = Pr(B∧C) = 0,

Pr(A∨B) = Pr(A∨C) = .95, Pr(B∨C) = .1, Pr(A∨B∨C) = 1,

Pr(A∧G) = .4, Pr(B∧G) = .03, Pr(C∧G) = .03, Pr(G) = .46,

where G is the proposition that I will get a bottle of Austrian wine. [More precisely, the probability space is <L, Pr> with L the propositional language over the set of propositional variables {A, B, C, G} and Pr such that Pr(A∧G) = .4, Pr(B∧G) = .03, Pr(C∧G) = .03, Pr(A∧¬G) = .5, Pr(B∧¬G) = .02, Pr(C∧¬G) = .02, Pr(A∧B) = Pr(A∧C) = Pr(B∧C) = Pr(¬A∧¬B∧¬C)= 0.] This is a fairly reasonable degree of belief function. Most wine from Austria is white wine or rosé, although there are some Austrian red wines as well. Furthermore I tend to use the principal principle whenever I can (assuming a close connection between objective chances and relative frequencies). Now suppose I learn that I will get a bottle of Austrian wine, G. My new degrees of belief are

Pr(A|G) = 40/46, Pr(B|G) = 3/46, Pr(C|G) = 3/46,

Pr(A∨B|G) = Pr(A∨C|G) = 43/46, Pr(B∨C|G) = 6/46, Pr(A∨B∨C|G) = 1.

G incrementally confirms B, C, B∨C, A∨C, B∨C, it neither incrementally confirms nor incrementally disconfirms A∨B∨C, and it incrementally disconfirms A.

However, my degree of belief in A is still more than thirteen times my degree of belief in B and my degree of belief in C. And whether I have to bet on these propositions or whether I am just curious what bottle of wine I will get, all I care about after having received evidence G will be my new degrees of belief in the various answers—and my utilities, including my desire to answer the question. I will be willing to bet on A at less favorable odds than on either B or C or even their disjunction; and should I buy new wine glasses for the occasion, I would buy red wine glasses. In this situation, incremental confirmation and degrees of incremental confirmation are at best misleading.

[What is important is a way of updating my old degree of belief function by the incoming evidence. The above example assumes evidence to come in the form of a proposition that I become certain of. In this case, probabilism says I should update my degree of belief function by Strict Conditionalization (see Vineberg 2000):

If Pr is your subjective probability at time t, and between t and t’ you learn E and no logically stronger proposition in the sense that your new degree of belief in E is 1, then your new subjective probability at time t’ should be Pr(•|E).

As Jeffrey (1983) observes, we usually do not learn by becoming certain of a proposition. Evidence often merely changes our degrees of belief in various propositions. Jeffrey Conditionalization is a more general update rule than Strict Conditionalization:

If Pr is your subjective probability at time t, and between t and t’ your degrees of belief in the countable partition {E₁, …, E_n, …} change from Pr(E_i) to p_i∈ [0,1] (with Pr(E_i) = p_i for Pr(E_i) ∈ {0,1}), and your positive degrees of belief do not change on any superset thereof, then your new subjective probability at time t’ should be Pr*, where for all A, Pr*(A) = Σ_iPr(A|E_i)•p_i.

For evidential input of the above form, Jeffrey Conditionalization turns regular probability measures into regular probability measures, provided no contingent evidential proposition receives an extreme value p ∈ {0,1}. Radical probabilism (Jeffrey 2004) urges you not to assign such extreme values, and to have a regular initial degree of belief function—that is, whenever you can (but you can’t always). Field (1978) proposes an update rule for evidence of a different format.

This is also the place to mention different formal frameworks besides probability theory. For an overview, see Huber (2008a).]

More generally, degrees of belief are important to us, because together with our desires they determine which acts it is rational for us to take. The usual recommendation according to rational choice theory for choosing one’s acts is to maximize one’s expected utility (the mathematical representation of one’s desires), that is, the quantity

EU(a) = Σ_{s ∈ S}u(a(s))•Pr(s).

Here S is an exclusive and exhaustive set of states, u is the agent’s utility function over the set of outcomes a(s) which are the results of an act a in a state s (acts are identified with functions from states s to outcomes), and Pr is the agent’s probability measure on a field over S (Savage 1972, Joyce 1999, Buchak 2014). From this decision-theoretic point of view all we need—besides our utilities—are our degrees of belief encoded in Pr. Degrees of confirmation encoding how much one proposition increases the probability of another are of no use here.

In the above example I only consider the propositions A, B, C, because they are sufficiently informative to answer my question. If truth were the only thing I am interested in, I would be happy with the tautological answer that I will get some bottle of wine, A∨B∨C. But I am not. The reason is that I want to know what is going on out there—not only in the sense of having true beliefs, but also in the sense of having informative beliefs. In terms of decision theory, my decisions do not only depend on my degrees of belief—they also depend on my utilities. This is the idea behind the plausibility-informativeness theory (Huber 2008b), according to which epistemic utilities reduce to informativeness values. If we take as our epistemic utilities in the above example the informativeness values of the various answers (with positive probability) to our question, we get

I(A) = I(B) = I(C) = 1, I(A∨B) = I(A∨C) ≈ 40/83, I(B∨C) = 60/83, I(A∨B∨C) = 0,

where the question “What bottle of wine will I get for my birthday?” is represented by the partition Q = {A, B, C} and the informativeness values of the various answers are calculated according to

I(A) = 1 – [1 – Σ_iPr*(X_i|A)²]/[1 – Σ_iPr*(X_i)²],

a measure proposed by Hilpinen (1970). Contrary to what Hilpinen (1970, 112) claims, I(A) does not increase with the logical strength of A. The probability Pr* is the posterior degree of belief function from our example, Pr(•|G). If we insert these values into the expected utility formula,

EU(a) = Σ_s∈Su(a(s))•Pr*(s) = Σ_X∈Qu(a(X))•Pr*(X) = Σ_X∈QI(X)•Pr*(X),

we get the result that the act of accepting A as answer to our question maximizes our expected epistemic utility.

Not all is lost, however. The distance measure d turns out to measure the expected utility of accepting H when utility is identified with informativeness measured according to a measure proposed by Carnap & Bar-Hillel (1953) (one can think of this measure as measuring how much an answer informs about the most difficult question, namely, which world is the actual one?). Similarly, the Joyce-Christensen measure s turns out to measure the expected utility of accepting H when utility is identified with informativeness about the data measured according to a proposal by Hempel & Oppenheim (1948). So far, this is only interesting. It gets important by noting that d and s can also be justified relative to the goal of informative truth—and not just by appealing to our intuitions about maximizing expected utility. When based on a regular probability, there almost surely is an n such that for all later m: relative to the conjunction of the first m data sentences, contingently true hypotheses get a positive value and contingently false hypotheses get a negative value. Moreover, within the true hypotheses, logically stronger hypotheses get a higher value than logically weaker hypotheses. The logically strongest true hypothesis (the complete true theory about the world w) gets the highest value, followed by all logically weaker true hypotheses all the way down to the logically weakest true hypothesis, the tautology, which is sent to 0. Similarly within the false hypotheses: the logically strongest false hypothesis, the contradiction, is sent to 0, followed by all logically weaker false hypotheses all the way down to the logically weakest false hypothesis (the negation of the complete theory about w). As informativeness increases with logical strength, we can put this as follows (assuming that the underlying probability measure is regular): d and s do not only distinguish between true and false theories, as do all confirmation measures (as well as all conditional probabilities). They additionally distinguish between informative and uninformative true theories, as well as between informative and uninformative false theories. In this sense, they reveal the following structure of almost every world w [w(p) = w(q) = 1 in the toy example]:

informative and contingently true in w
p∧q

> 0 contingently true in w
p, q, p↔q

uninformative and contingently true in w
p∨q, ¬p∨q, p∨¬q

= 0 logically determined
p∨¬p, p∧¬p

informative and contingently false in w
¬p∧¬q, p∧¬q, ¬p∧q

< 0 contingently false in w
¬p, ¬q, p↔¬q

uninformative and contingently false in w
¬p∨¬q

This result is also true for the Carnap measure c, but it does not extend to all confirmation measures. It is false for the Milne measure r, which does not distinguish between informative and uninformative false theories. And it is false for the Good-Fitelson measure l, which distinguishes neither between informative and uninformative true theories nor between informative and uninformative false theories. For more see Huber (2005b).

The reason c, d, and s have this property of distinguishing between informative and uninformative truth and falsehood is that they are probabilistic assessment functions in the sense of the plausibility-informativeness theory (Huber 2008b)—and the above result is true for all probabilistic assessment functions (not only those that can be expressed as expected utilities). The plausibility-informativeness theory agrees with traditional philosophy that truth is an epistemic goal. Its distinguishing thesis is that there is a second epistemic goal besides truth, namely, informativeness, which has to be taken into account when we evaluate hypotheses. Like confirmation theory, the plausibility-informativeness theory assigns numbers to hypotheses in the light of evidence. But unlike confirmation theory, it does not appeal to intuitions when it comes to the question why one is justified in accepting hypotheses with high assessment values. The plausibility-informativeness theory answers this question by showing that accepting hypotheses according to the recommendation of an assessment function almost surely leads one to (the most) informative (among all) true hypotheses.

It is idle to speculate what Hume would have said to all this. Suffice it to note that his problem would not have gotten off the ground without our desire for informativeness.

8. References and Further Reading

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Carnap, Rudolf & Bar-Hillel, Yehoshua (1953), An Outline of a Theory of Semantic Information. Technical Report 247. Research Laboratory of Electronics, MIT. Reprinted in Y. Bar-Hillel (1964), Language and Information. Selected Essays on Their Theory and Application. Reading, MA: Addison-Wesley, 221-274.
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Author Information

Franz Huber
Email: franz@caltech.edu
California Institute of Technology
U. S. A.

Guo Xiang (c. 252—312 C.E.)

Guo Xiang (also known as Kuo Hsiang and Zixuan) is the author of the most important commentary on the classic Daoist text Zhuangzi (Chuang-tzu). He is responsible for the current arrangement of thirty-three chapters divided into inner, outer and miscellaneous sections. His commentary represents a substantial philosophical achievement that has been compared to the Zhuangzi itself. Ostensibly the purpose of a commentary should be to elucidate the ideas in the original text. However, Guo’s Zhuangzi commentary adds many original ideas. It is possible to delve deeper into their meaning by examining the text on which he is commenting as if it were a commentary on the work of Guo. The fact that Guo chose to present his philosophy this way—within the framework of this Daoist classic—has served as a blueprint for the manner in which Confucians, Daoists and, increasingly from Guo’s time, Buddhists have engaged in constructive dialogue, building systems of thought which include the strengths of all three systems.

Life and Work
Central Concepts
Guo Xiang’s Influence on Chinese Thought
References and Further Reading

1. Life and Work

Very little is known about the life of Guo Xiang. He lived in a time of great political upheaval and yet his own political career was one of consistent and significant success. He maintained a high position within one of the six rebellious factions that contributed to the rapid demise of the Western Jin Dynasty (265-316 CE). This fact is interesting because unlike such contemporary figures as Ji Kang (223-262 CE) or Ruan Ji (210-263 CE), who both retired from what they saw as a corrupt governmental system, Guo remained to play what he regarded as the proper role of an engaged public dignitary.

Like the other great figure of the xuanxue (mysterious or profound learning) movement, Wang Bi (Wang Pi, 226-249 CE), Guo sought to synthesize the accepted Confucian morality within an ontological system that would encompass the insights expressed in the Zhuangzi and the Daodejing (Tao Te Ching). But while Wang Bi put the greatest emphasis on the unitary nature of reality, particularly in the concept of wu (nothingness), Guo emphasized individuality and interdependence. Guo’s position is not as diametrically opposed to Wang’s as is often assumed, Guo does not claim there is a dualist or objective reality to the world around us and he does maintain the use of dao as the unitary, nameless and formless basis of reality. This reality is expressed as a process Guo calls “self-transformation” or “lone transformation” (zihua or duha) in which all things are responsible for their own creation and for the set of relationships that exist between themselves and the rest of the world. Our self-transformation was and is at each moment conditioned by all the self-transformations coming before us and we in turn condition all the self-transformations that come after us. By shifting the focus onto those relationships, Guo arrives at a view of the transcendent sage that is radically different and innovative. While the traditional view of a Daoist sage was someone who removed himself from the mundane world, for Guo this notion is false and misleading. The social and political environments in which people relate to each other are no less natural than a forest or mountaintop and to a person who appreciates why she exists in the particular relationship to others in which she does, the proper course of action is not to run away, but to become involved. In other words, we must become engaged with the world around us, but not because of a continuous state of existence that we share with people and things around us, rather, it is because of a continuous act of creation that at its core makes us responsible for the world and its proper maintenance.

Ji Kang and Ruan Ji pursued the ideal of “overcoming orthodox teaching and following nature” (yue mingjiao er ren ziran). “Orthodox teaching” (mingjiao) includes the proper behavior being matched to the proper role, such as for a parent, a child, a ruler or a subject. Different xuanxue figures accepted these ideals to different extents, but nearly all held them in distinction to ziran, naturalness or spontaneity. Guo’s concept of ziran contained all governmental and social spheres, so it made no sense to try to set the realms of mingjiao and ziran in opposition to each other. For Guo, the roles required by Confucian propriety are not imposed upon a natural system that would otherwise be in chaos. They are, instead, the natural result of the system of spontaneous self-transformation and chaos is merely what results when one fails to recognize one’s proper role. Guo directs much of the Zhuangzi‘s advice about equalizing apparent contradiction in this direction.

There is some controversy over the true authorship of Guo’s commentary to the Zhuangzi. The earliest source, the Jin Shu (Standard History of the Jin Dynasty), accuses Guo of plagiarizing all but two chapters of the commentary from Xiang Xiu (d. 300 CE), writing a generation earlier. Current scholarship, while acknowledging that Guo made use of Xiang Xiu’s work and other earlier commentaries, still credits Guo as the principal author. The evidence for this recognition falls into three main areas. Firstly, the most innovative philosophical features in the commentary do not correspond with those in other works by Xiang Xiu. Secondly, in the early twentieth century, a postface to the commentary was discovered which details the work Guo carried out and finally, various linguistic analyses and references in other works suggest that Guo is the principal author.

2. Central Concepts

a. Lone/Self-transformation and the Absence of a Creator

Guo calls the process by which all things come into existence “lone transformation” (duhua) or “self-transformation” (zihua). The claim that all things share equally in creating the world does not deny that differences exist, but it does deny that these differences translate into differences of value. That one person may be less talented or intelligent than another does not affect the worth of that person, but rather helps determine the proper role for him to play

Given the importance of self-transformation in Guo’s philosophical system, he wished to deny any organizing principle. Even Wang Bi’s emphasis on wu (nothingness) came too close to occupying the place of an original cause. It was necessary for Guo to draw the line clearly, even if it meant contradicting the text on which he was commenting. In a note to a section of the Zhuangzi that leaves open the question of whether there is a creator, Guo writes:

The myriad things have myriad attributes, the adopting and discarding [of their attributes] is different, as if there was a true ruler making them do so. But if we search for evidence or a trace of this ruler, in the end we will not find it. We will then understand that things arise of themselves, and are not caused by something else. (Zhuangzi commentary, chapter 2)

b. Ziran, Action and Nonaction

The natural, spontaneous state of affairs that results from the process of self-transformation is ziran. Ziran is a compound of two different terms zi, meaning “self” and ran, meaning “to be so,” and can be translated as “nature,” “the self-so,” or “things as they are.” While many other Daoist thinkers distinguish ziran from the mundane social world in which we live, for Guo they are identical. Even social hierarchy is the natural result of how things come to be as themselves. When we follow our natures, the result is peace and prosperity. When we oppose them, the result is chaos.

Thus, Guo seeks to provide a specific interpretation to the doctrine of nonaction (wuwei). He writes that “taking no action does not mean folding one’s arms and closing one’s mouth” (Zhuangzi commentary, chapter 11). In chapter 3 of the Zhuangzi, we encounter the story of Cook Ding, who carves an ox, not by using his senses or dexterity, but by equating his idea of who he is with his situation and the task at hand. For Guo, if one has correctly perceived the way in which all things share in the creation of ziran, then correct action in the world will follow naturally.

Therefore, what Guo means by ziran is very different from what Western philosophers refer to as “the state of nature.” Ziran is the expression of a naturally peaceful and harmonious system, available to all who can recognize their place.

c. Comfort with One’s Role (an qi fen)

One key to the correct appreciation of one’s place in the world is Guo’s concept of fen, meaning “share” or “role.” Guo employs the idea of qi (ch’i), “vital energy” or “vital essence,” to explain the manner in which the dao imbues the world with life-giving force. One’s natural allotment of qi therefore determines one’s fen. The proper functioning of the world and the personal happiness of the people in it is maintained by the correct appreciation of one’s place. This is not to say Guo denies the possibility of growth and change, which are clear and necessary parts of nature, including social systems. In the same way that the body has hands, feet and head that play different roles according to their different endowments, so the world functions best when people act according to their proper fen. Thus, one’s fen is both the allotment of qi received from heaven and the role one must maintain within the system. Indeed, there is no difference between natural abilities and social obligations.

d. The Sage

For Guo, the Sage (shengren) is someone who directs his talent and understanding for the benefit of society. The phrase neisheng waiwang describes someone who is internally like a sage and outwardly acts as a ruler. In Guo’s view, the former necessitates the latter. In chapter one of the Zhuangzi, we read the story of the sage ruler Yao, who attempts to cede his throne to the recluse Xu You, but is rebuffed. In the story, it is clear that Xu You has a greater level of understanding than does Yao, but Guo’s commentary presents the matter differently:

Are we to insist that a man fold his arms and sit in silence in the middle of some mountain forest before we say that he is practicing nonaction? This is why the words of Laozi and Zhuangzi are rejected by responsible officials. This is why responsible officials insist on remaining in the realm of action without regret … egotistical people set themselves in opposition to things, while he who is in accord with things is not opposed to them … therefore he profoundly and deeply responds to things without any deliberate mind of his own and follows whatever comes into contact with him … he who is always with the people no matter what he does is the ruler of the world wherever he may be. (Zhuangzi commentary, chapter 1)

It seems clear from these sentiments that in Guo’s view not only is Yao a better model for a ruler than Xu You, but also that Confucius is a better model for a sage than Zhuangzi.

3. Guo Xiang’s Influence on Chinese Thought

The Zhuangzi has long been held in high regard as one of the main pillars of Daoist philosophy, as well as one of the most accessible, entertaining and popular philosophical works of any genre. However the important contribution of Guo to the way in which we understand the Zhuangzi is less well known, particularly in its non-Chinese translations. He deserves credit not only for the external editing and arrangement of the text, but more importantly for developing a philosophical framework that allows for the continued dominance of accepted Confucian codes of proper behavior, yet still keeps open philosophical discussion of wider insights on the nature of reality. While the earlier work of Wang Bi may have eased the entry of Buddhism into the Chinese mainstream, it is within the framework provided by Guo that the three strands of Buddhism, Daoism and Confucianism have found a strategy for coexistence that has contributed to the success and growth of them all.

4. References and Further Reading

Allison, Robert E. Chuang-Tzu for Spiritual Transformation. Albany: State University of New York Press, 1990.
Aoki, Goro. “Kaku Sho Soshichu shisen” [Examining Guo Xiang’s Zhuangzi commentary]. Kyoto kyoiku gaku kiyo 55 (1979): 196-202.
Chan, Alan K.L. “Guo Xiang.” In The Encyclopedia of Chinese Philosophy, ed. Anthonio S. Cua, New York: Routledge, 2003, 280-284.
Chan, Wing-tsit, ed. A Source Book in Chinese Philosophy. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1963.
- A good selection of translated passages in addition to an excellent treatment of Guo Xiang’s thought and xuanxue in general.
Feng, Yu-lan (Feng Youlan) trans. Chuang Tzu: A New Selected Translation with an Exposition of the Philosophy of Kuo Hsiang, Shanghai: Commercial Press, 1933. (Reprint, New York: Gordon, 1975.)
Feng, Yu-lan (Feng Youlan). A History of Chinese Philsosophy, v. 2, trans. Derk Bodde. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1953.
Fukunaga, Mitsuji. “Kako Sho no Soshi chu to Ko Shu no Shoshi chu” [Guo Xiang’s Zhuangzi commentary and Xiang Xiu’s Zhuangzi commentary]. Toho gakuho 36 (1964): 187-215.
- This was some of the groundbreaking work on the Xiang Xiu controversy. Its findings are summarized in English by Livia Knaul’s article in The Journal of Chinese Religions.
Fukunaga, Mitsuji. “‘No-Mind’ in Chuang-tzu and Ch’an Buddhism.” Zinbun 12 (1969): 9-45.
Holtzman, Donald. “Les sept sages de la forêt des bambous et la société de leur temps.” T’oung Pao 44 (1956): 317-346.
Knaul, Livia. “Lost Chuang-tzu Passages.” Journal of Chinese Religions 10 (1982): 53-79.
- This article contains a translation of the “lost” postface, as well as a detailed treatment of the Xiang Xiu controversy.
Knaul, Livia. “The Winged Life: Kuo Hsiang’s Mystical Philosophy.” Journal of Chinese Studies 2.1 (1985): 17-41.
Kohn, Livia. Early Chinese Mysticism: Philosophy and Soteriology in the Taoist Tradition. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1992.
Kohn, Livia. “Kuo Hsiang and the Chuang-tzu.” Journal of Chinese Philosophy 12 (1985): 429-447.
Mair, Victor H., ed. Experimental Essays on Chuang-tzu. Honolulu: University of Hawaii Press, 1983.
Mather, Richard B. “The Controversy Over Conformity and Naturalness During the Six Dynasties.” History of Religions 9 (1969-1970): 160-180.
Robinet, Isabelle. “Kouo Siang ou le monde comme absolu.” T’oung Pao 69 (1983): 73-107.
Tang Yijie. Guo Xiang. Taibei: Dongda tushugongsi, 1999.
- One of the most acclaimed biographers of Guo Xiang. Not currently translated into English.
Yü, Ying-shih. “Individualism and the Neo-Taoist Movement in Wei-Chin China.” In Individualism and Holism: Studies in Confucian and Taoist Values, ed. Donald Munro (Ann Arbor: Center for Chinese Studies, University of Michigan, 1985), 121-155.
Ziporyn, Brook. The Penumbra Unbound: The Neo-Taoist Philosophy of Guo Xiang. Albany: State University of New York Press, 2003.
Ziporyn, Brook. “The Self-So and Its Traces in the Thought of Guo Xiang.” Philosophy East and West 43 (1993): 511-539.
Zhuang Yaolang. Guo Xiang xuanxue. Taibei: Liren shuju, 2002.

Author Information

J. Scot Brackenridge
Email: Scot.Brackenridge@liu.edu
Long Island University
U. S. A.

Religious Language

The term “religious language” refers to statements or claims made about God or gods. Here is a typical philosophical problem of religious language. If God is infinite, then words used to describe finite creatures might not adequately describe God. For example, is God good in the same sense that Secretary-General of the United Nations Kofi Annan is good? This difficulty challenges us to articulate the degree that attributes used for finite beings can be used for God and what these attributes mean when they describe God. The ambiguity in meaning with respect to the terms predicated of God is the “problem of religious language” or the “problem of naming God.” These predications could include divine attributes, properties, or actions. Since the doctrines of the divine in Eastern religious traditions differ radically from the doctrines of the Abrahamic traditions, the problem of religious language has not been accorded much attention in Eastern philosophy.

The problem of religious language is worrisome to practitioners of the Abrahamic religious traditions because it has the potential to undermine those traditions. All three faiths proclaim truths about God in written texts, commentary traditions, and oral teachings. In fact, speech about God is essential to both personal praxis and organized celebration in these traditions. Without adequate solution to the problem of religious language, human speech about God is called into question. Without the ability to speak about God and to understand the meaning of what is spoken, the Abrahamic faiths are vulnerable to the criticism that their sacred texts and teachings are unintelligible.

The problem of religious language also provides a challenge for philosophers of religion. If there is no adequate solution to the problem of religious language, large discussions in the domain of philosophy of religion will also be rendered unintelligible. For example, philosophers of religion debate the nature of divine foreknowledge and human freedom. These claims about God would be rendered unintelligible if human speech about God is impossible. Thus, the problem of religious language is a philosophical problem that must be solved in order to provide a framework for understanding claims about God in both the house of worship and the academy.

What Generates the Problem of Religious Language?
Solutions to the Problem
1. Statements about God are Meaningless
2. Other Possible Solutions: An Overview
Conclusion
References and Further Reading

1. What Generates the Problem of Religious Language?

In contemporary discussions, it is not the question of God’s existence that generates the problem of religious language. If God does not exist, any attempt to describe God will be an inaccurate description of reality. Discussions about religious language attempt to articulate how one could speak of God if, in fact, God exists. The problem of religious language is generated by the traditional doctrine of God in the Abrahamic traditions. Since God is thought to be incorporeal, infinite, and timeless, the predicates we apply to corporeal, finite, temporal creatures would not apply to God.

The problem of religious language is also generated by the medieval doctrine of divine simplicity, which claims that God does not have any intrinsic accidental properties. Intrinsic properties are distinguished from Cambridge properties, such that the acquisition or loss of a Cambridge property by a subject does not entail a change in that subject, while the acquisition or loss of an intrinsic property by a subject entails a change in that subject. Moreover, accidental properties are distinguished from essential properties such that if a subject were to acquire or lose an accidental property, the subject would still be a member of its species. However, if a subject were to acquire a new essential property or lose an essential property, that subject would no longer be a member of its species. Thus, statements such as, “God is P,” where P is an intrinsic accidental property would be ruled out by divine simplicity. For example, the statement, “Kofi Annan is good,” means that some property goodness is a property of Kofi. When one says, “God is good,” it would appear that this statement means that some property goodness is a property of God. But if the doctrine of divine simplicity is true, it is impossible that God have the intrinsic accidental property of goodness. Rather, God is goodness. That is, God’s essence includes goodness and God is identical with his essence. Consequently, whenever someone applies a positive attribute to God they are speaking falsely, for God does not have properties in the way that creatures have properties. Although divine simplicity is a doctrine associated with medieval thinkers, it has been defended in the twentieth century by Eleonore Stump and Norman Kretzmann, among others.

2. Solutions to the Problem

Historically, there have been at least four different solutions to the problem of religious language. Although no single solution has been widely accepted by the philosophical community, some of the solutions have fallen into disrepute.

a. Statements about God are Meaningless

Some philosophers have argued that statements about God do not have truth-values and are thus meaningless or unintelligible. These claims are derived from the views of the Vienna Circle, a group of early twentieth century logical empiricists who developed a test for the truth-value of statements known as Verificationism.

Rudolf Carnap (1891-1970) argued that the only way one could be certain of a statement’s truth or falsity was by verifying those statements through perceptions, observations, or experience. He offers the following example of the process by which a statement could be verified:

Let us take the statement P1: “This key is made of iron.” There are many ways of verifying this statement: for example,: I place the key near a magnet; then I perceive that the key is attracted.

Here the deduction is made in this way: Premises: P1: “This key is made of iron”; The statement to be examined. P2: “If an iron thing is placed near a magnet, it is attracted;” this is a physical law, already verified.

P3: “This object – a bar – is a magnet;” statement already verified.

P4: “The key is placed near the bar;” this is now directly verified by our observation.

From these four premises we can deduce the conclusion: P5: “The key will now be attracted by the bar.”

This statement is a prediction which can be examined by observation. If we look, we either observe the attraction or we do not. In the first case we have found a positive instance, an instance of verification of the statement P1 under consideration; in the second case we have a negative instance, an instance of disproof of P1. (Carnap 1966, 208).

Having established the principle of verification, Carnap then argues that metaphysical assertions such as, “The principle of the world is water,” cannot be verified. (Ibid. 210). Since metaphysical assertions cannot be verified, they are meaningless. One cannot assess the truth-value of a metaphysical assertion because such assertions cannot be empirically verified.

A.J. Ayer (1910-1989) agreed with Carnap, and thus inferred that since all statements about God cannot be verified, they too are meaningless, “But the notion of a person whose essential attributes are non-empirical is not an intelligible notion at all. We may have a word which is used as if it names this ‘person,’ [God] but, unless the sentences in which it occurs express propositions which are empirically verifiable, it cannot be said to symbolize anything.” (Ayer 1946, 144). Thus, on the basis of Verificationism, statements about God do not have truth-values that can be verified and, thus, are unintelligible expressions. So at least one solution to the problem of religious language is to claim that statements about God are unintelligible.

But Verificationism was challenged by philosophers such as Alonzo Church and Richard Swinburne and largely abandoned in the twentieth century. A.J. Ayer identified and defended a “weak principle of verification” in his seminal paper, “The Principle of Verifiability.” He admitted that empirical propositions are not conclusively verifiable, but argued that in order for a claim to be factual, and thus to have its truth-value determined, it must be verifiable by some possible observations. (Ayer 1936, 199). While Ayer didn’t specify exactly what those possible observations must be, he argued that they need to be the kinds of observations that could verify an assertion.

In response, Richard Swinburne argues that the premises defending weak Verificationism are false. He offers the following example of an argument in defense of weak Verificationism: “It is claimed that a man could not understand a factual claim unless he knew what it would be like to observe it to hold or knew which observations would count for or against it; from which it follows that a statement could not be factually meaningful unless there could be observational evidence which would count for or against it.” (Swinburne 2000, 151).

Swinburne then argues that the premise of the above argument is false, since one could understand a statement if one understands the words forming that statement and if those words are organized in a grammatically significant format. Thus, there could be factual statements that do not have evidence either for or against them and one could understand them. Consequently, metaphysical assertions invoking God and his properties cannot be ruled out as meaningless by weak Verificationism.

Ayer modified his principle of verification for the second edition of his book, Language, Truth and Logic, as follows:

A statement is directly verifiable if it is either itself an observation-statement, or is such that in conjunction with one or more observation-statements it entails at least one observation-statement which is not deducible from these other premises alone; and I propose to say that a statement is indirectly verifiable if it satisfies the following conditions: first, that in conjunction with certain other premises it entails one or more directly verifiable statements which are not deducible from these other premises alone; and secondly, that these other premises do not include any statement that is not either analytic, or directly verifiable, or capable of being independently established as indirectly verifiable. (Ayer 1946, 13).

In a review of the second edition, Alonzo Church argued that even according to Ayer’s revised principle of verification, any statement whatsoever or its negation is verifiable:

For let O1, O2, O3 be three “observation-statements” (or “experiential propositions”) such that no one of the three taken alone entails any of the others. Then using these we may show of any statement S whatever that either it or its negation is verifiable, as follows. Let –O1 and –S be the negations of O1 and S respectively. Then (under Ayer’s definition) –O1O2 v O3–S is directly verifiable, because with O1 it entails O3. Moreover S and –O1O2 v O3–S together entail O2. Therefore (under Ayer’s definition) S is indirectly verifiable – unless it happens that –O1O2 v O3–S alone entails O2 , in which case –S and O3 together entail O2 , so that –S is directly verifiable. (Church 1949, 53).

Church’s objection was so devastating, that Ayer’s definition of verifiability from the second edition of his book was largely abandoned. Despite repeated attempts by various thinkers such as Kai Neilson to reformulate a principle of verification successfully, Verificationism has been continually rejected as an inadequate methodology. As Ruth Weintraub points out in a recent paper, almost no one defends Verificationism in the twenty-first century. (Weintraub 2003, 83).

b. Other Possible Solutions: An Overview

There are at least three solutions to the problem of religious language other than the view that statements about God are meaningless. The first solution argues that when terms are used to describe God and his attributes, those terms are equivocal with respect to what they mean in reference to God and what they mean in reference to creatures. Consequently, this solution would argue that God is not good in the same sense in which Kofi is good; God’s goodness is entirely different from the goodness of a creature. Despite this tremendous difference in kind, God can be spoken of by human beings through negations. Rabbi Moses ben Maimon (Maimonides) (1135-1204) is one of the most famous proponents of this doctrine. He argued for this position in his Guide for the Perplexed. His view has been defended in the twentieth century by, among others, Harry Austryn Wolfson (1887-1974) and Kenneth Seeskin (1947- ).

The second solution argues that when terms are used to describe God and his attributes, those terms are univocal with respect to what they mean in reference to God and what they mean in reference to creatures. This approach would argue that God is good in the same sense in which Kofi is good. In the contemporary literature William Alston argues that there are some concepts that can be applied univocally to God and to human beings, but he rejects a completely univocal solution.

The third solution argues that when terms are used to describe God and his attributes, those terms are used analogously. This solution argues that God is good in an analogous sense to Kofi’s goodness. “Good” applied to both God and to Kofi would signify the same thing, but in different modes. That is, when “good” is applied to Kofi it picks out a property of Kofi, but when “good” is applied to God, it refers to the unity that is God’s essence and not to an individual property. This approach provides a middle position between an equivocal solution and a univocal solution, since terms used analogously aren’t entirely equivocal nor are they entirely univocal; terms used analogously signify the same thing but in different modes. This is the approach of St. Thomas Aquinas (1225-1274). He defends this position in his Summa theologiae as well as his Summa contra Gentiles. The analogical approach as been defended in the contemporary literature by a number of philosophers, including Ralph McInerny (1929-).

i. Equivocal Language

Maimonides, like Aquinas, is committed to the doctrine of divine simplicity, as it is described in Section 1 above. It is for this reason that he rejects affirmative attributes with respect to God, with some exceptions. Although it is accurate to characterize Maimonides’ solution to the problem of religious language as equivocal, it certainly includes more than just equivocations. One can speak of God through negations. For example, one can say, “God is not dead,” in order to signify that God lives. One can speak of God also through naming the divine actions, such as, “God creates.” However, the Maimonidean attribute of action is not to be understood as identical with the Aristotelian accident of action. Attributes of action are understood to be events by Maimonides, while Aristotle (384-322 BCE) understands actions to be accidents or properties that inhere in a substance. Since Maimonidean attributes of action are not properties, they do not abrogate divine simplicity.

One might oppose Maimonides on this point by arguing that actions imply composition in their subject, and thus that they would abrogate divine simplicity. For example, in the statement, “Zayd stood,” the fact that Zayd stands shows that Zayd has a special feature, namely, the ability or power to stand. So the action of standing implies that Zayd has the power to stand. This ability introduces composition in Zayd in that it shows that Zayd is composed of “the power to stand” among all his other properties. Consequently, Maimonides would be mistaken in arguing that actions do not introduce composition in their subject. In fact, it looks as if each action will introduce a separate power in the agent, thus multiplying the composition in the agent. So for every divine action, God will have a separate power in himself.

Maimonides addresses this objection by arguing that multiple actions could be brought about by a single power or ability. (Maimonides 1966, Vol. I, 53). He uses the example of the heat generated by a fire, which can burn, blacken wood, cook food, and so forth. So, one should not assume that a multiplicity of actions entails a multiplicity of powers in the agent. In the fire example, the heat of the fire produces multiple actions. The same could be said about an agent who acts by virtue of his will. Consequently, Maimonides argues that God brings about multiple actions and effects through his will, which is contained in his essence but not as a property, and that the multiplicity of effects or actions does not entail a multiplicity of powers in God.

According to Maimonides, predicates such as qualities or relations are to be denied of God. For example, one should say, “God is not a body,” but one cannot say correctly, “God is merciful.” While there are biblical passages that contain some of these imperfections, they are written in the language of human beings. Maimonides attempts to interpret these passages to eliminate or to deny the imperfections. His foundational assumption is that these passages do not ascribe to God anything that could be viewed as a deficiency. For example, passages that refer to God’s “body parts” are to be interpreted as indicating God’s actions. Maimonides argues that when the Bible indicates that God has an eye, “eye” indicates the intellectual act of apprehension performed by God. This act of apprehension does not imply composition in God insofar as it is an attribute of action, so it can be attributed to God without compromising divine simplicity. Qualities that are attributed to God in the Bible, such as “merciful,” mean that God performs acts that resemble certain acts done by human beings out of a given quality such as mercy. But “merciful” does not indicate what God is like or what his nature is; “merciful” only refers to a certain kind of action. Taken as a quality, terms such as “merciful” are applied to God equivocally. So we cannot say that God has certain qualities such as “mercy” in the same sense in which we would say “Kofi is merciful,” because God’s simplicity precludes his having the quality of mercy. Nor can we speak of any relation of similarity between God and creatures. Relations are accidental properties and God does not have accidental properties. So any relation between God and another thing must be denied of God.

With respect to God, the so-called essential attributes (for example, living, existing, incorporeal, eternal, powerful, knowing, willing, and one) are interpreted equivocally. According to Maimonides, these attributes indicate composition in God and they purport to indicate a feature of God’s essence. In order to preserve divine simplicity, Maimonides interprets these attributes as signifying “the negation of the privation of the attribute in question” with respect to God. A privation is the absence of the existence of a habit. For example, blindness would be a privation of sight. So one could say, “The wall does not see.” Maimonides would not say that the wall is blind, because the only things that could be blind are those things that could or should have the capacity for sight. A wall never has the capacity for sight, although a wall is unseeing. So the negation of the privation of the attribute of seeing in the case of the wall indicates that the property of sight is not fittingly said of the wall, even in a negative sense. In the case of God, essential attributes are to be interpreted as indicating that those attributes are not fittingly said of God, even in a negative sense. For example, “God is living,” would be interpreted to signify, “God is not dead,” which is taken to mean that “dead” is not fittingly said of God. A similar procedure is to be followed for the other essential attributes, none of which are appropriately said of God, even in negations.

In summary, according to Maimonides, we can only say what God is not and what actions he performs. The standard objection to Maimonides’ solution is that it is incompatible with the religious practices and assumptions of his own tradition, Judaism, and with those of the other Western monotheisms. Aquinas argues that an equivocal approach to God would undermine religious practices. Any demonstration about God would be formally invalid, as it would include an equivocation. Any communication about God would be severely limited because we cannot make any affirmative claims about God or his nature. Given that the divine actions are named equivocally through a perceived similarity to creaturely actions, how can human beings know what they mean? Even through the divine actions, God is unknowable. Consequently, Aquinas argues that one should look for a means of naming God that does not fall prey to these problems and that is in keeping with religious practices. It is on this basis that he defends the way of analogy as a preferable solution.

It is important to note that Maimonides’ pessimism with respect to what can be said about God is derived largely from his metaphysical commitment to divine simplicity. If this commitment were removed, then Maimonides would have more latitude with respect to religious language. However, other religious doctrines in the Abrahamic traditions preclude a wholly univocal solution to the problem, as will become evident in the next section.

ii. Univocal Language

A modern proponent of univocity is William Alston. Alston, however, does not defend complete univocity, in which ordinary terms are used in the same sense of God and creatures, because he recognizes that divine otherness, especially divine incorporeality, would preclude complete univocity. (Alston 1989a, 65). However, he argues that two different things could possess the same abstract feature in different ways,

A meeting and a train of thought can both be “orderly” even though what it is for the one to be orderly is enormously different from what it is for the other to be orderly. A new computer and a new acquaintance can both be “intriguing” in a single sense of the term, even though what makes the one intriguing is very different from what makes the other intriguing. (Ibid., 66-67).

Having pointed out that two different kinds of things can possess the same abstract feature in different ways, Alston argues that God and human beings can possess the same abstract feature in different ways. For example, a human being can know a particular fact and God can know that same fact. But how God knows something or the way that God knows something will be different from the way that a human being knows something insofar as God is incorporeal, omniscient, and so forth. According to Alston, the difference in the way knowledge is acquired doesn’t prevent us from saying that the psychological concept, “knows p,” can be applied to both human beings and to God. Moreover, one can also apply functionalist concepts, which are concepts of a certain functional role in the psyche, to both human beings and to God. Alston offers the following description of functionalist concepts,

The concept of a belief, desire or intention is the concept of a particular function in the psychological economy, a particular “job” done by the psyche. A belief is a structure that performs that job, and what psychological state it is – that it is a belief and a belief with that particular content – is determined by what that job is . . . . Our ordinary psychological terms carry no implications as to the intrinsic nature of the structure, its neurophysiological or soul-stuff character. . . . Thus, on this view, psychological concepts are functional in the same way as many concepts of artifacts, for example, the concept of a loudspeaker. (Ibid., 67-68).

Since functionalist concepts are indifferent as to the nature of the structure of the psyche in which they inhere, it is possible to apply a functionalist concept to both a human being and to God in the same sense. According to Alston:

We can say of a human being that she will tend to do what she can to bring about what she recognizes to be best in a given situation, and we can take this tendency to be partly constitutive of the concept of recognizing something to be best. We can then formulate the divine regularities in tendency terms also. Thus it will be true of God also that if He recognizes that it is good that p He will tend to bring about p insofar as He can unless He recognizes something incompatible with p to be a greater good. (Ibid., 79).

Alston claims that this example illustrates his method of applying functionalist concepts to God and to human beings univocally. According to Alston, the tendency statements are true of God, but the core of common meaning between human beings and God is to be found in the concept of “recognizing something to be best.” Alston further claims that although both God and human beings can be said to perform the function “recognizing something to be best,” human beings do not always assess the situation correctly, but God does. Since God and human beings perform the same function, albeit in a different way, the functionalist concept “recognizing something to be best” can be applied truly to both entities with a common core of meaning. So it would be true to say of God that he recognizes something to be best and that this concept can be applied to him and to human beings in the same sense. Thus, Alston argues that functionalist concepts can be constructed in such a way that they apply in the same sense to God and creatures, and he identifies this position as “partial univocity.”

At least one of the limitations of Alston’s view is that the predicates that are frequently used of God in the historical religious traditions, for example, “good,” and that are applied also to human beings cannot be applied univocally to God; only constructed terms, for example, “recognizing something to be best,” could be applied univocally to God. Therefore, with respect to the historical religious traditions, Alston’s view is not of much help. A religious believer, for example, might ask herself the question whether or not God could be said truly to be good. Alston can’t provide an answer to this question, because he intentionally limits partial univocity to functionalist concepts. If goodness could be expressed in a functionalist concept such as “recognizing something to be best,” then God could be said truly to possess this predicate in the same sense as a human being who shares the same predicate. But functionalist concepts are descriptive of mental states and so one might wonder if the equation of goodness with a particular mental state is a sufficiently robust description of goodness.

Second, one might wonder why Alston believes that God performs the same functions as human beings, given divine otherness. Presumably, he would argue that mental states would be the same in two minds, regardless of how the minds are constructed or out of what materials they are constructed. Granting this point, on what basis does Alston reject complete univocity between the functionalist concepts of the two minds? If the nature and constituents of their minds does not prevent the two minds from having the same mental state, why would Alston deny that there is a complete univocity between them? Complete univocity is probably denied because of divine otherness. But divine otherness has to do with, for example, divine incorporeality. Divine incorporeality would impinge upon how God’s mind is constructed, but this would be irrelevant for the functionalist concepts. One wonders if Alston should be committed to a completely univocal view, given his account of functionalist concepts.

Given the limitations of Alston’s view and some of the unanswered questions that arise concerning it, it is appropriate to turn our attention to the third possible solution to religious language, which is the view of St. Thomas Aquinas.

iii. Analogical Language

Aquinas argues that the when terms are used to describe God and his attributes, those terms are used analogously. Thus, when the predicate “good” is applied to God, it doesn’t pick out a property that God has. Owing to divine simplicity, God does not have properties. When predicated of God, “good” refers to the unity that is God’s essence. So when “good” is attributed to God and to Kofi, it signifies the same thing in both attributions, but it signifies this thing in different modes.

Aquinas grounds his analogical approach in the causal relation that obtains between God and creatures. In his discussion of analogy, Aquinas outlines the following points:

1) Human beings name things as they know them (Aquinas, Ia,.13.1).
2) Human beings know God from creatures.
3) God causes the existence of creatures (Ibid., 12.8).
4) Creatures resemble God just as an effect resembles its agent cause.

On the basis of the resemblance between creatures and God, human beings can infer that certain perfections of created things are present in God and they can name these perfections. Thus, the foundation for an analogy of names between creatures and God is the causal relationship that holds between God and creatures. >

Aquinas affirms the principle that effects resemble their efficient or agent causes. His account of the similarity between an agent cause and its effect includes a shared form. According to Aquinas, there are at least two different kinds of forms: substantial forms and accidental forms. Substantial forms configure the matter or physical stuff in which they inhere. They contribute a set of essential properties to a substance, such as rationality. A substantial form is the essence of a substance, which is a matter-form composite such as a human being. Accidental forms are non-essential properties, such as perfections or qualities. Aquinas explains that creaturely perfections are associated with both substantial forms and accidental forms;

“God alone is good essentially. For everything is called good according to its perfection. Now perfection of a thing is threefold: first, according to the constitution of its own being; secondly, in respect of any accidents being added as necessary for its perfect operation […] Thus, for instance, the first perfection of fire consists in its existence, which it has through its own substantial form; its secondary perfection consists in heat, lightness and dryness […] This […] perfection belongs to no creature by its own essence; it belongs to God only, in Whom alone essence is existence; in Whom there are no accidents; since whatever belongs to others accidentally belongs to Him essentially, as, to be powerful, wise, and the like.” (Ibid., 6.3.).

According to Aquinas, there is a perfection associated with a thing’s substantial form and there are the added perfections that attach to the essence of a thing as accidents. In both cases, these perfections are derived from God. However, insofar as the shared forms are found in more eminent mode in God than in a creature, the creature will be less perfect than God. Consequently, the shared form cannot share a univocal name. However, the shared forms are not wholly different (otherwise they couldn’t be shared) and so they cannot share an equivocal name. Thus, Aquinas argues that the shared forms also share an analogical name, which would be neither univocal nor equivocal. So human beings can name God’s perfections by way of analogy, on the basis of the causal relationship that holds between God and creatures. It is on this basis that one could say, “God is good,” and, “Kofi is good,” where “good” is understood to be said truly of both God and Kofi, even though God is good essentially and Kofi possesses goodness only as an accidental property.

Despite the similarities that exist between God and creatures, there are many ways in which creatures do not resemble God. So when one names God, one must be cognizant of the differences between God and creatures as well as the similarities so that one does not make a false attribution to God. So although Aquinas thinks that God can be named on the basis of the resemblance that holds between him and creatures, Aquinas acknowledges that this resemblance is limited and that therefore not all terms that are correctly applied to creatures may be correctly applied to God. For example, any terms indicating corporeality cannot be applied to God since God is incorporeal.

In order to affirm the naming of God by analogy along with the doctrine of simplicity, Aquinas makes a distinction between the mode of signification of a name (modus significandi) and the thing signified by a name (res significata). This distinction is not made by Maimonides, so he is unable to use it in his attempt to provide a solution to the problem of religious language. Owing to divine simplicity, the divine names will be different in mode than the same names as applied to creatures. For example, when “good” is applied to a creature it will signify that the property “goodness” inheres in the creature. However, when “good” is applied to God it will signify that “goodness” is somehow included in God’s essence, but not as a property. The mode of signification of human language is inherently defective with respect to God since it always picks out predicates as accidental properties. God doesn’t have accidental properties. In contrast, the thing signified by names such as “good” belongs properly to God and more so to God than to creatures, since any goodness that could be found in a creature is derived from God as the creator. One could say, “Kofi Annan is good,” and one could say, “God is good,” where “good” is included in God’s essence in a higher mode and to a greater degree than the property “goodness” inheres in Kofi Annan.

One might think that with respect to perfection terms the thing signified would be applied univocally between God and creatures. But, according to Aquinas, things are named univocally when they have both the same name and the same definition of the name. The definition of the name would include both the mode of signification and the thing signified by the name. So in the case of perfection terms applied to God and to creatures, the thing signified by the name would be the same but the mode of signification would be different. So although the thing signified would be the same, the name would not be said univocally between God and creatures. God’s perfection isn’t a matter of quantity such that he just has more perfection than a creature does. The manner in which he possesses a given perfection is different from the manner in which a creature possesses that same perfection, since God is simple and creatures are not.

One might think that if we reject divine simplicity, all reasons for naming God analogically would disappear. But this isn’t quite right. As Alston points out, the problem of religious language can be generated by divine otherness. So even absent divine simplicity, Aquinas would be likely to argue for an analogy between creatures and God. However, Aquinas doesn’t limit his approach to religious language solely to analogies. He also approves of naming God by virtue of negations, but he doesn’t limit speech about God to negations.

Alston provides a recent objection to Aquinas’ analogical solution. He argues that serious problems arise in connection with the thing signified by the name, as Aquinas understands it. This is so because Aquinas is unable to specify completely God’s perfections. Moreover, he cannot make explicit what likeness holds between God and creatures because all names fall short of him. According to Alston, there are too many ambiguities in Aquinas’ view.

But Aquinas has an answer to this objection in his recourse to the principle that every effect is like its agent cause. Aquinas knows this principle in general based upon observations of other agent causes, such as artisans who craft artifacts, and he applies this principle to God by virtue of the arguments that God is the first efficient (agent) cause. (Aquinas, Ia., 2.3). Thus, God cannot be wholly different from creatures in the way that Alston suspects.

Alston argues that since the thing signified by the name is indeterminate with respect to God, we cannot know, for example, what “God is good” means. But Aquinas would take issue with the inference from the first claim to the second, on the grounds of the relationship between created effects and God. Perfections such as goodness are found both in the created effect and in God, but in God they are found in a different mode and to a greater degree. So “God is good” is not meaningless nor is it the case that we do not know what “God is good” means. We know that goodness is found in God somehow, in a different mode and to a different degree. So “God is good” is a true statement. In fact, “good” is said primarily of God, rather than creatures, because “good” is given to creatures via the causal relationship. The thing signified by “good” is indeterminate in the sense that we do not know exactly to what degree it is found in God, except that the mode is different and the degree is greater than that found in creatures. But this degree of indeterminateness does not entail the kind of agnosticism about the divine attributes that Alston suggests. Consequently, Alston’s objection is unsuccessful.

Despite the virtues of Aquinas’ approach to naming God, there are some obvious drawbacks for his view. In particular, his view requires a medieval metaphysics that most contemporary philosophers would find questionable. For example, he believes in a causal relation between creatures and God. However, in comparison with the other two solutions and their respective disadvantages, Aquinas makes a strong case in favor of his view.

3. Conclusion

With respect to the problem of religious language, multiple solutions have been suggested and defended. Four of these solutions have been presented in this entry. The first solution suggests that all statements about God are meaningless. The second solution suggests that all attributes predicated of God are to be interpreted equivocally. The third solution suggests that the attributes predicated of God are to be interpreted univocally. The fourth solution suggests that the attributes predicated of God are to be interpreted analogously.

While no single solution has emerged to the satisfaction of all religious communities or philosophers of religion, three of the historical solutions offer a way in which statements about God might be understood. Maimonides’ solution severely limits the degree to which human beings can speak about God. Alston’s solution raises at least two objections that require a satisfactory response and a possible modification of his proposal. Finally, the solution of Aquinas requires a medieval metaphysic in which one affirms the relation of creation between creatures and God, a foundation many contemporary individuals would reject. Consequently, there is much research and thought that is still to be done on the problem of religious language. The historical solutions offered here provide a tenuous beginning in that direction and show promise for the emergence of a satisfactory solution.

4. References and Further Reading

Alston, William P. “Religious Language.” In The Oxford Handbook of Philosophy of Religion. Ed. William J. Wainwright. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2005. pp. 220-244.
Alston, William P. “Aquinas on Theological Predication: A Look Backward and A Look Forward.” In Reasoned Faith: Essays in Philosophical Theology in Honor of Norman Kretzmann. Ed. Eleonore Stump. Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 1993.
- Alston provides several objections to Aquinas’ analogical solution to the problem of religious language.
Alston, William P. “Functionalism and Theological Language.” In Divine Nature and Human Language: Essays in Philosophical Theology. Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 1989a.
Alston, William P. “Can We Speak Literally of God?” In Divine Nature and Human Language: Essays in Philosophical Theology. Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 1989b.
Alston, William P. “Divine and Human Action.” In Divine Nature and Human Language: Essays in Philosophical Theology. Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 1989c.
Aquinas, Saint Thomas. Summa Theologiae. Trans. by Fathers of the English Dominican Province. New York: Benziger Bros., 1948.
- Aquinas’ most famous work, which summarizes his views on a variety of theological and philosophical topics.
Aristotle. Categories and On Interpretation. Trans. Hugh Tredinnick. Loeb Classical Library. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1938.
- Two of Aristotle’s logical works, which include discussions of actions, accidents, logic and the truth-conditions of assertions.
Ayer, A. J. “The Principle of Verifiability.” In Mind. vol. 45, no. 178 (Apr 1936), pp. 199-203.
- Ayer’s defense of weak Verificationism.
Ayer, A. J. “God-Talk is Evidently Nonsense.” In Philosophy of Religion. Ed. Brian Davies. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2000. pp. 143-147.
- In this extract from his book, Language, Truth and Logic, Ayer argues that since assertions about God cannot be empirically verified that they are therefore meaningless.
Ayer, A. J. Language, Truth and Logic. 2nd ed. New York: Dover Publications: 1946.
Carnap, Rudolf. “Philosophy and Logical Syntax: Part I.” In 20th-Century Philosophy: The Analytic Tradition. Ed. Morris Weitz. New York: The Free Press, 1966. pp. 207-219.
- Carnap’s groundbreaking lecture on Verificationism and its implications for metaphysics.
Church, Alonzo. “Review of A.J. Ayer’s Language, Truth and Logic, Second Edition,” in Journal of Symbolic Logic. vol. 14, no. 1, (March 1949), pp. 52-53.
Konyndyk, Kenneth. “Verificationism and Dogmatism” in International Journal for Philosophy of Religion. vol. 8, no. 1 (1977), pp. 1-17.
- In this article, Konyndyk canvasses Kai Neilsen’s attempts to formulate a successful principle of verification and argues that each formulation is unclear and ambiguous.
Kretzmann, Norman and Eleonore Stump, Eds. The Cambridge Companion to Aquinas. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1993.
Maimonides, Moses. The Guide of the Perplexed. 2 vols. Trans. Shlomo Pines. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1963.
- Maimonides’ famous work, which summarizes his views on a variety of theological and philosophical topics, and includes various polemics against Islamic theologians.
McInerny, Ralph. Aquinas and Analogy. Washington, DC: Catholic University of America Press, 1996.
Neilsen, Kai. Contemporary Critiques of Religion. (London: Weidenfeld and Nicolson, 1973).
- In this work, Neilsen offers his own principle of Verification, which is subsequently criticized by Kenneth Konyndyk.
Seeskin, Kenneth. “Sanctity and Silence: The Religious Significance of Maimonides’ Negative Theology.” In American Catholic Philosophical Quarterly. 76 (2002): pp. 7-24.
Seeskin, Kenneth, Ed. The Cambridge Companion to Maimonides. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2005.
Stump, Eleonore and Norman Kretzmann. “Absolute Simplicity.” In Faith and Philosophy. 2, (1985), pp. 353-382.
- A contemporary defense of the medieval doctrine of divine simplicity.
Stump, Eleonore. Aquinas. New York: Routledge Press, 2003.
- A contemporary articulation and defense of many of Aquinas’ most important views on topics both theological and philosophical, including an excellent treatment of Aquinas’ views on form.
Swinburne, Richard. “God-Talk is not evidently nonsense.” In Philosophy of Religion. Ed. Brian Davies. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2000. pp. 147-152.
- In this extract from his book, The Coherence of Theism, Swinburne argues that weak Verificationism is founded on a false premise.
Weed, Jennifer Hart. Creation as a Foundation of Analogy in Aquinas,” forthcoming in Divine Transcendence and Immanence in the Thought of St. Thomas Aquinas (Leuven: Peeters, 2006).
- A contemporary analysis of Aquinas’ account of divine causality and the kind of resemblance that holds between creatures and their creator, with a brief discussion of how this resemblance functions in Aquinas’ method of naming God analogically.
Weed, Jennifer Hart. “Maimonides and Aquinas: A Medieval Misunderstanding?” In Revista Portuguesa de Filosofia. Forthcoming in 2006.
- A contemporary comparison between Maimonides’ via negativa and Aquinas’ way of analogy, along with a re-examination of Aquinas’ alleged misunderstanding of Maimonides’ method.
Weintraub, Ruth. “Verificationism Revisited,” in Ratio. Vol. XVI, (March 2003), pp. 83-98.
- In this paper, Weintraub points out that almost no one defends Verificationism in the contemporary philosophical community.
Wolfson, Harry Autryn. Studies in the History of Philosophy and Religion. Eds. Isadore Twersky and George H. Williams. 2 vols. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1977.
- A collection of Wolfson’s papers, primarily on Jewish philosophy and medieval philosophy.

Author Information

Jennifer Hart Weed
Email: jweed@unb.ca
University of New Brunswick
Canada

Mental Causation

The term “mental causation” applies to causal transactions involving mental events or states, such as beliefs, desires, feelings, and perceptions. Typically, the term is used to refer to cases where a mental state causes a physical reaction: for instance, the mental state of perceiving a Frisbee flying your way can cause the physical event of your springing up to catch it. It should also be recognized that mental causation covers those cases where the causal transaction occurs just among mental states themselves, as when one entertains a series of thoughts while planning, deliberating, solving a problem, remembering, and so on. The term “mental causation” need not cover such exotica as minds bending spoons (if such feats are to be believed), psychosomatic illnesses, or controlling one’s body through yogic meditation. Simply waving your hand (a physical event) because you wish to greet a friend (a mental event) suffices for counting as an instance of mental causation.

The phenomenon of mental causation, as may be apparent, is thoroughly commonplace and ubiquitous. But this is not the only reason why it is significant. It is absolutely fundamental to our concept of actions performed intentionally (as opposed to involuntarily), which, in turn, is central to those of agency, free will, and moral responsibility. An action, as philosophers use the term, is not a mere bodily motion like involuntarily blinking one’s eyes. It is something one does intentionally, as when one winks to grab someone’s attention. The distinction between a mere bodily movement and an action hinges on the possibility of mental causation, since actions have mental states, such as intentions, as direct causes. This distinction, in turn, is critical for gauging moral responsibility, since we attribute or withhold judgments of moral responsibility depending upon whether the agent acted intentionally.

While the phenomenon of mental causation seems obvious enough, the explanation of how it is possible is far from obvious. There are certain putative marks distinctive of mental states that pose problems for their capacity to wield causal powers, marks such as: being a non-physical substance (problem of spatial location and problem of conservation); failing to conform to law-like regularities (problem of anomalism); being extrinsic to an agent’s body (problem of externalism); and being supplanted by brain states (problem of exclusion).

Background to the Problem of Mental Causation
Traditional Problem of Mental Causation
1. The Problem of Spatial Location
2. The Problem of Conservation
Contemporary Problems of Mental Causation
1. Background to the Contemporary Problems of Mental Causation
2. Three Contemporary Problems of Mental Causation
Conclusion: Where We Are Now
References and Further Reading

1. Background to the Problem of Mental Causation

a. Dualism v. Reductive Materialism

The main assumption that generates problems for mental causation is dualism, the view that mental phenomena and physical phenomena are fundamentally different from each other. In particular, the mental is not reducible to the physical: constructing a physical duplicate of a conscious person does not guarantee that the physical duplicate has a mind. René Descartes (1596 – 1650) is the classic source for defenses of dualism. The view that the mental is so reducible is known as reductive materialism, which maintains that mental phenomena are nothing but a species of physical phenomena, which consist of purely physical substances, physical properties, and physical laws governing their behavior.

Reductive materialism does not face the problem of mental causation, because mental causation, being nothing more than a species of physical causation, is no more problematic than just plain old physical causation. Not so for dualism.

b. Substance Dualism v. Property Dualism

Dualism comes in two main versions: substance dualism and property dualism. Standard discussions divide the issue along the traditional problem of mental causation and the contemporary problem of mental causation. The former is generated by the form of dualism known as substance dualism, while the latter generated by what is known as property dualism. It is actually more accurate to say of both problems that there are several sub-problems associated with each.

Substance dualism comes out of the traditional Christian conception of a person as consisting of both a body and a soul that can survive the destruction of the body. Descartes offered the most fully developed formulation of substance dualism (also called “Cartesian dualism,” after its founder), so called because the idea is that the mind and the body constitute each their own “substance.” A substance, on Descartes’s view, is anything that can logically exist on its own, where something can logically exist on its own if one can coherently conceive of that individual without having to conceive of it with anything else – a pumpkin, a cow, a ball of wax; things that are not substances would be things like a sense of humor or a friendly smile, as they need to be a part of something else in order for us to conceive of them coherently (a person, in the case of humor, and a face, in the case of a smile). Descartes’s formulation of substance dualism maintains that the mind has no physical features – no mass, shape, spatial dimension, and so on. The mind, in other words, has no physically detectable qualities. Furthermore, under this formulation, the body has no mental features. This basically means that the brain does not think, feel, or perceive, a rather odd view by today’s standards.

Property dualism, by contrast, allows for the brain to think, feel, and perceive, for it allows that all substances are physical, but it maintains that thoughts, feelings, and perceptions are instances of mental properties that are not reducible to physical properties. Properties, unlike substances, are repeatable; that is, a single property, such as the color orange, can occur in many different substances – a pumpkin and a squash can both be orange. Examples of mental properties are things like the belief that it is raining, the desire to stay dry, and other propositional attitudes, as well as sensations, like pains, itches, and tickles. According to property dualism, an individual who has exactly the same physical properties as a conscious person may still lack mental properties. Both property dualism and substance dualism allow for the possibility of what philosophers of mind call zombies. These are not the brain-dead stalkers of Hollywood, but rather creatures that are physically identical to a fully conscious individual that nonetheless lack a mental life. Property dualism and substance dualism differ in that substance dualism entails property dualism, but the converse is not true.

c. Standard Models of Mind-Body Interaction

There are four basic models of mind-body interaction. These are:

interactionism, the view that the mind and the body directly cause things to happen in each other;
parallelism, the view that the mind and the body act “in parallel,” but never casually interact directly;
epiphenomenalism, the view that only the body has causal powers, but the mind is causally inert; and finally,
reductionism, the view that the mind just is the body, and so whatever causal efficacy the physical has, the mental also has.

These models can each be formulated in terms of the vocabulary of either substance dualism or property dualism. In this entry, the models will be neutral between these two versions of dualism.

What these models say and how they differ are best understood when applied to a concrete example. Take the case where you have the misfortune of stubbing your toe. The trauma to your toe sends signals through nerves in your leg and torso that stimulate those neural tissues responsible for the capacity to experience pain – call them C-fibers, the neural correlate of pain. The crucial question is how the term “correlate” is specified: is the correlation causal or non-causal, and if causal, do the effects themselves have causal powers or not? The different models give us different answers to this question.

i. Interactionism

The critical feature of interactionism is its commitment to “two-way” causation – mental-to-physical causation and physical-to-mental causation. Here is the interactionist’s story. When you stub your toe (call this event a), this stimulates the C-fibers in your brain (call this event b). This neural event b causes you to experience the sensation of pain (event c.). The pain you feel causes you to get annoyed (event d), causing a neural event (e), which is the neural correlate of annoyance.

A diagram may be helpful here. Causal transactions are represented by arrows. Mental events (like pain and annoyance) go above the bar, and physical events (like stubbing your toe, C-fiber stimulation (CFS), and the neural correlate of annoyance (N)) go below it.

mental-causation-fig1

Objections to Interactionism: As the picture makes clear, causation flows from the mental to the physical and from the physical to the mental. Indeed, this is the hallmark of interactionism, which is depicted by the arrows from (b) to (c) and (d) to (e). Interactionism is probably the most common view held by the folk, but as will be explained below, it faces the problem of spatial location and the problem of conservation.

ii. Parallelism

Dualism does not necessarily entail interactionism, since one can be a dualist and yet maintain that there is no causal interaction between the mental and the physical. This is parallelism. On this model, mental and physical events do not causally interact; they only co-occur. When causal transactions do occur, they occur only between members of their own kind: mental events enter into causal transactions only with other mental events, and physical events enter into causal transactions only with other physical events.

mental-causation-fig2

Parallelism raises the following pressing question: what guarantees that the mental event and its physical correlate will be appropriately coordinated? Why do we feel pain upon bodily trauma on a regular basis, or seek water when we are thirsty rather than whistle a tune, or elevate our arm when we want to raise it rather than raise our foot? Our minds and bodies are remarkably well coordinated for two systems that are supposed to have no causal contact with each other.

There are two different accounts of how the coordination is achieved: pre-established harmony, the view of Gottfried Leibniz (1646 – 1716) and occasionalism, the view of Nicolas Malebranche (1638 – 1715). Both appeal crucially to God as the source of mind-body coordination. According to Leibniz’s pre-established harmony (1695), the proper pairing of a mental event and a bodily event was long established by God. As Leibniz explains, the mind and the body are like two separate clocks wound up in advance to chime at precisely the same time. On this view, God is thus fairly “hands-off” when it comes to coordinating an individual’s mind with her body, having done all the work ahead of time.

Not so on the view developed by Malebranche. According to Malebranche’s occasionalism, coordination is achieved on an event by event basis; whenever someone wants to raise her arm, God is right there to make her arm go up (Malebranche 1958, 2:316). The basis for this view stems out of a previous commitment to a certain view about causation according to which only God can bring about causes and effects.

Objections to Parallelism: To modern ears, this convenient appeal to God to solve the coordination problem is untenable and just too convenient. In defense of pre-established harmony and occasionalism, we need to understand that they are driven by prior commitments about the nature of God and the world as God created it, not simply introduced to solve a problem about mind-body coordination. However, those who reject the metaphysical schemes of Leibniz and of Malebranche will find these solutions unsatisfactory.

iii. Epiphenomenalism

Epiphenomenalism is the view that physical events cause mental events, but mental events never cause anything, not even other mental events. It is thus a partial concession to interactionism, as it allows for causation in “one direction” – from the physical to the mental – and so it denies parallelism, as it insists upon causal contact from the physical to the mental. The mind, on this model, is like a shadow cast by the body, where the body is the only thing that makes things happen – the mind is just “projected” and is causally inert. This analogy is inexact, for even shadows do darken the regions upon which they are cast, and at times, frighten or amuse or do other things. But mental events are not supposed to do anything, according to epiphenomenalism, not even cause other mental events.

mental-causation-fig3

As odd as the model may initially appear, there is a compelling motivation for it. It does not encounter the coordination problem faced by parallelism, because it allows for mental events to be causally grounded by their physical causes. Thus, the reason why, say, one feels pain upon stubbing one’s toe is that the stubbing causes the C-fiber stimulation, which then causes the pain in a law-like manner.

Objections to Epiphenomenalism: In spite of its stated virtues, epiphenomenalism has been thought to be unappealing, precisely because it does not credit the mind with any causal efficacy. Consequently, epiphenomenalism is logically consistent with the complete absence of mentality; mindless bodies would function in exactly the same way, as the mind has no capacity to generate any causal impact. In short, epiphenomenalism denies that there is any mental causation. Even parallelism allows for the mind to have a measure of efficacy since mental events can, at least, cause other mental events. But under epiphenomenalism, not even this limited causal efficacy is accorded to the mind. This makes epiphenomenalism quite objectionable.

iv. Reductionism

With all the difficulties encountered by interactionism, parallelism, and epiphenomenalism, one may wonder why we don’t construe the mind in wholly physical terms – why, that is, we don’t just identify the mental with the physical. This is the idea behind reductionism. On this view, mental events just are physical events; the difference between the mental and the physical lies only in how we conceive of them, not in how they really are. Thus, there are concepts that are about mental phenomena and concepts that are about physical phenomena, but it is possible for a mental concept and a physical concept to pick out one and the same physical event.

mental-causation-fig4

As Figure 4 indicates, mental events just are physical events; there are no events that are non-physical. For this very reason, mental causation is just a species of physical causation, and is therefore no more problematic than plain old physical causation. On this view, mental causation is just physical causation that has been conceptualized using mental concepts, or described using mental vocabulary.

Objections to Reductionism: While reductionism has the virtue of presenting a clear account of mental causation, it faces the problem of justifying the reducibility of the mental to the physical. There are compelling reasons for thinking that the mind is not just a purely physical phenomenon. Descartes, for instance, gives us two arguments for the irreducibility of mental substances to physical substances. The first is the argument from divisibility, which basically claims that the mind cannot be physical, as physical things have spatial dimension but minds simply are not the kinds of things that have spatial dimension. And the second is the argument from conceivability, according to which it is conceivable that the conceiver does not have a body, but not conceivable that the conceiver does not have a mind. While contemporary philosophers no longer work within the framework of substance dualism, there are other considerations that have been used to support the irreducibility of mental properties to physical properties (for the irreducibility of phenomenal properties, see Jackson 1982, Nagel 1974, Kripke 1980, Chalmers 1996; for the irreducibility of intentional properties, see Davidson 1970, Child 1994).

2. Traditional Problems of Mental Causation

The traditional problem of mental causation begins with the idea that the mind is its own substance that has no physical characteristics. In the absence of physical characteristics, it becomes quite puzzling how the mind is supposed to exert any causal influence. There are two ways of formulating the problem: the Problem of Spatial Location and the Problem of Energy Conservation.

a. The Problem of Spatial Location

This problem is based upon a certain assumption about the nature of causation – that the cause and its effect must be spatially contiguous (touch each other, so to speak), and thus have spatial location. The spatial location requirement has ample intuitive support: a stone does not move unless something pushes against it; a pot of water does not boil unless heat is directly applied to it; a plant does not grow unless its roots draw water from the soil; and so on. (Typically, a given effect has multiple causal factors whose conjunction is necessary for the effect, and conversely, a given cause produces more than one effect. Since nothing hangs on observing this nicety, this entry will help itself to the simplifying talk of one cause per effect and one effect per cause.) In each of these cases, the causes and their effects are in spatial contact in one way or another. As a general matter, nowhere in nature is there causation where the cause or effect has no spatial location. But this is precisely what Cartesian mind-body interaction asks us to believe. The problem can be summed up by the inconsistency among the following statements:

Mental causation: The mind and the body causally interact – thoughts, feelings, and perceptions, bring about bodily actions.
Spatial location: Wherever there is causation, the cause and its effect must have spatial location.
Dualism: The mind has no spatial location – there is no spatial location to thoughts, feelings, or perceptions.

The claim about mental causation (1) and the claim about spatial location (2) are very intuitive, so dualism would lose much credibility if it could not make sense of how the two claims could be true under dualism. However, the three claims do not look like they are consistent with each other. If causes and effects must have spatial location, as (1) maintains, then the mental cause of a bodily event must occur in a spatial location. But (2) denies that mental events have spatial location, so the assertion that there is mental causation (3) is not consistent with the conjunction of (1) and (2). Descartes’s colleagues were quite open about their puzzlement. Pierre Gassendi, for instance, asked:

How can there be effort directed at anything, or motion set up in it, unless there is mutual contact between what moves and what is moved? (Cottingham, et al., 1984, p, 236).

Princess Elizabeth of Bohemia, another contemporary of Descartes, was even more forthright about her puzzlement:

[T]he determination of movement seems always to come about from the moving body’s being propelled – to depend on the kind of impulse it gets from what sets it in motion, or again, on the nature and shape of this latter thing’s surface. Now the first two conditions involve contact, and the third involves that the impelling thing has extension; but you utterly exclude extension from your notion of soul, and contact seems to me incompatible with a thing’s being immaterial (Anscombe and Geach 1954, pp. 274 – 5).

There are two standard dualist strategies to handle the problem: the Pineal Gland Reply and the Reply from Quantum Mechanics.

Pineal Gland Reply: Descartes proposed that we could locate the workings of mental causation in the pineal gland, which Descartes believed to be the gateway between the mind and the body. We now know that the pineal gland is responsible for regulating the hormone melatonin, but aside from Descartes’ anatomical inaccuracy, the strategy of appealing to a physical locus is fundamentally misguided, because it does nothing to solve the problem. For how, one is right to ask, can mental causation occur “in” the pineal gland if the mind cannot be located “in” anything, lacking as it is in spatial dimension?

Reply from Quantum Mechanics: This reply rejects (2), the spatial location constraint upon causes and effects as inaccurate. The basis for this rejection is certain alleged findings in quantum mechanics where the position of a traveling particle, such as an electron, is indeterminate. That is, there is a chance that a particle will show up in a certain region but its presence in that region is purely a matter of chance, and yet for all its lack of a determinate spatial location, it is still capable of entering into causal relations. Perhaps minds are like this as well; they can cause things to happen even if they have no determinate location. Or so the reply goes. There are three difficulties with this reply. First, the comparison between minds and fundamental physical particles is imperfect, for electrons can have a location, albeit indeterminate, whereas minds, according to the Cartesian conception, cannot have any location at all. Second, the jury is still out on the interpretation of these alleged findings; for all we know, some theory will be able to explain away the appearance of indeterminacy and model the universe after strictly deterministic principles. And third, no entities outside of the domain of fundamental physics – macro-physical entities – have this odd indeterminacy about their occurrence or location, and so it appears too convenient to proclaim of minds, a macro-entity by any standards, that it is like the micro-physical entity of electrons in this one respect.

b. The Problem of Conservation

This problem draws upon two key assumptions. The first is the idea that causation is a matter of energy transfer, such as when one pool ball transfers its momentum to another ball upon collision, or when the calories from ingesting food get converted into bodily energy. (For energy transfer accounts of causation, see Aronson 1985, Dowe 2000, Fair 1979, and Salmon 1994.) The second is the principle of the conservation of energy, a fundamental law of nature that is taken to be a cornerstone of contemporary science. According to this principle, the total quantity of energy in the universe remains fixed at all times. Energy, of course, comes in many forms – kinetic, chemical, electrical, thermal, and so on – and energy can be transformed from one form to another, and loss or gain of energy can happen within a component part of the universe, but the sum total energy in the universe as a whole can be neither created nor destroyed. The principle of conservation entails a significant lemma, which is that the physical universe is a causally closed system: at no point in the history of the physical universe can there be outside energy causing something to happen within the system, nor can energy leave the system to cause something to happen outside of it.

Insofar as the body is a part of the physical system, it cannot be caused to move by anything other than something else within that system. But if the mind is not a part of that system, as Cartesian dualism maintains, then its causal influence upon the body would be a foreign source of energy impinging upon the energy equilibrium of the universe, thereby violating conservation. The inconsistency here is present in the following statements:

Mental causation: The mind and the body causally interact; thoughts, feelings, and perceptions, bring about bodily actions.
Conservation: The physical universe is a causally closed physical system: causal interactions do not increase nor decrease its sum total energy of the universe.
Dualism: The mind is not a part of the causally closed physical system: mental events, such as thoughts, perceptions, and sensations, do not occur within the system.

Again, these statements cannot be true together. The conjunction of (1) and (3) entail a disruption in the balance of energy in the physical universe, but (2) denies that this can happen.

Reply from Rejection of Conservation: This reply rejects (2) by appealing to what is known as “tunneling,” a quantum mechanical phenomenon found in certain types of radioactive decay. When a particle “tunnels,” it effectively escapes a barrier that requires more energy than it could inherently have, creating a sudden surge of energy that temporarily disrupts conservation. It is as if a 10 horse-power motor put out 11 horse-power out of nowhere. The application of this possibility to dualistic mental causation is tempting: if the non-physical desire to raise one’s arm disrupts the overall energy balance when it causes one’s arm to go up, the mental event “tunnels” to our brain, thereby explaining the disruption of the sum total of energy. We certainly cannot rule out this scenario from our armchairs, but this reply is problematic, for the same reason that it was found problematic when claiming that the mind could be like electrons in having indeterminate spatial location. Tunneling is found only at the subatomic level and nowhere else in the natural world. We do not find it in biology, geology, astronomy, or in any of the other special sciences. Thus, there is no reason to expect the phenomenon of tunneling in the realm of mental events.

3. Contemporary Problems of Mental Causation

a. Background to the Contemporary Problems of Mental Causation

The traditional problem of mental causation lies in the commitment to substance dualism. The contemporary problem, on the other hand, lies in its commitment to property dualism, along with other assumptions concerning token physicalism, the causal efficacy of mental events versus the causal relevance of mental properties, and conditions for causal relevance.

i. Token Physicalism

Contemporary approaches to the mind typically work within the framework of physicalism, the view that everything that exists in space-time is exclusively physical or constituted by the physical. The optimal way of formulating the doctrine of physicalism is itself a substantive issue (for comprehensive discussions, see Poland 1994, Gillett and Loewer 2001, Melnyk 2003, Kim 2005), but the version that most philosophers work with, or react to, in the mental causation literature, is token physicalism (see Donald Davidson 1970). According to token physicalism, each mental event is a particular (also called a token), which is numerically identical with a physical particular; this means that a mental event is an occurrence of an event in the brain or of some other suitably complex physical medium. The converse, on the other hand is not necessarily true, since there are physical events that are not mental, such as tsunamis, apples falling to the ground, magnets attracting iron filings, and so on.

We can illustrate the concept of token identity this way. Say that Alice sneezes in such a way that the sneezing event was both a loud noise a as well as an emission of a virus b. If the loud noise was indeed one and the same event as the emission of the virus, then we can say that a is token identical with b. The token identity of a mental event and a physical event conforms to this idea: some mental occurrence was one and the same event as a physical occurrence. On Davidson’s view, an event is a mental event m just in case it has a mental property M (or it is describable in terms of mental predicates); similarly for the relevant aspects of physical events. To say, then, that a mental event m is token identical with a physical event p is to say that m and p are just one and the same thing, one event having both M and P.

Token physicalism it is to be carefully distinguished from what is known as type physicalism, the view that each mental property M is identical with, or reducible to, a physical property P. Particulars are unrepeatable (that is, they are bound to a unique spatio-temporal region) whereas types are repeatable (that is, they can show up in different things and at different times). The idea behind type physicalism can be illustrated this way. The property roundness (call it “R”) and the property circularity (“C”) are both types, as they are repeatable. As it happens, they are one and the same type, which means that any particular having R necessarily has C. The difference between token physicalism and type physicalism is basically this: whereas token physicalism only entails that every particular thing having a mental property also has some physical property or other, type physicalism entails that for each mental property, there is a physical property with which that mental property is identical.

The advantage of token physicalism is that it allows a mental event to enter into causal transactions in a way that does not violate the spatial location constraint upon causes, and therefore, does not face the Problem of Spatial Location: physical events have spatial location, so if m and p are token identical, then m has whatever spatial location p has. Nor does it run afoul of the Problem of Conservation: m just is p (and thus not distinct from p), so m‘s causal efficacy does not add anything extra over and above the causal efficacy of the event p.

ii. The Causal Efficacy of Events versus the Causal Relevance of Properties

Nonetheless, token physicalism still faces problems accounting for mental causation. While mental events are one thing, the mental properties in virtue of which those events are efficacious are another; for a single event can have many properties, but only some of them may be involved in bringing about an effect. Here is an example of this. Suppose one steps on a banana peel and falls smack down to the ground. The banana peel has many properties: its slipperiness and its yellowness, for instance. But, surely the causally relevant property was the slipperiness of the peel, not the color of the peel, for had the peel not been slippery, the falling would not have occurred (all things being equal), but the falling still would have occurred even if the peel were a different color. To track this distinction, let us use the term “efficacy” for events and “relevance” for the properties of events.

The troubling idea, then, is that while a mental event may be causally efficacious insofar as it is an event, only its physical properties, and not its mental ones, are causally relevant for bringing about the effect. An example of this is the following. Suppose Alice sneezes, causing Bob to catch her cold. Suppose also that the sneezing event was a loud noise as well as an emission of a virus. Then, while it is true to say that the loud noise caused Bob’s cold, as the loud noise is the same event as the emission of the virus, surely it was only the event’s being an emission of a virus that was causally relevant to the onset of Bob’s illness. Under token physicalism, the worry is that mental properties are like the property of being a loud noise – completely irrelevant to bringing about the effect. This is the worry that drives the contemporary problems of mental causation, which are manifest in the problem of anomalism, the problem of externalism, and the problem of exclusion. But before introducing these problems, it will be helpful to lay out a rough account of what it means for a property to be causally relevant or irrelevant.

iii. A Test for Causal Relevance

What test can we use to determine whether a property is causally relevant or not? This is a different question from the question of what it takes for a property to pass that test. Here, we just want to lay out the test. Let us be clear that properties are causally relevant to something or other, typically, to the instantiation of other properties. Causal relevance is thus a 4-place relation where the relata consist of the cause event c, the effect event e, and properties F of c and G of e, wherein c causes e to instantiate G in virtue of the fact that c has F.

To gauge whether properties are causally relevant or irrelevant, philosophers appeal to the following conditions or counterfactuals:

Property F is causally relevant to property G only if:

Suppose F and G occurred; then if F had not occurred, then G would not have occurred;

Suppose F and G had not occurred; then if F had occurred, then G would have occurred;

There is no H such that had H occurred without F, G would not have occurred, or had F occurred without H, G would still have occurred.

Conditions (1) – (3) convey the idea that G’s occurrence is contingent upon F’s occurrence. More specifically, (1) says that F’s occurrence is necessary for G: G doesn’t or can’t occur unless F occurs. (2) says that F’s occurrence necessitates G: F guarantees G’s occurrence. Finally, (3) says that F is not a mere spurious cause of G: F does not merely accompany the property H that happens to be the one that’s doing the real causal work. Failure to satisfy any of the three conditions would indicate that the candidate property is not causally relevant.

It is important to appreciate that these conditions are only to test for whether a property is causally relevant. As it was said earlier, they do not answer the question of what it takes for a property to pass that test. One way to put this point is to distinguish between the truth conditions for a claim and the truth makers for the claim: the truth makers of the claim describe the fact, mechanism, or elements, in virtue of which the claim is true. Thus, they do not form an analysis, certainly not a full analysis, as they are only necessary conditions that may not be jointly sufficient. A genuine analysis requires that one specify both necessary and sufficient conditions as well as what it is in virtue of which these very conditions hold – the truth-maker.

b. Three Contemporary Problems of Mental Causation

In contemporary discussions of mental causation, there are three stumbling blocks for the satisfactions of the conditions for causal relevance in the case of mental properties. These are: the problem of anomalism, the problem of externalism, and the problem of exclusion.

i. Problem of Anomalism

The basic root of the problem of anomalism is the thesis of psychophysical anomalism, the claim that there are no strict, exceptionless, laws involving mental states. The problem has been acknowledged by many philosophers, but its most explicit formulation has been laid out by Kim (Kim 1989). On a widely received view about causal relevance, a property is causally relevant only if it is “nomically subsumed,” that is, if it appears in a strict law. The denial that mental properties can appear in laws of this kind naturally threatens to render mental properties causally irrelevant. The threat of epiphenomenalism posed by the problem of anomalism can be formulated thus:

Nomic Subsumption: A property can be causally relevant only if it appears in a law.
Anomalism: Mental properties do not appear in laws.
——————————————————
Epiphenomenalism: Mental properties cannot be causally relevant.

This problem of anomalism has its origin in Davidson’s theory of anomalous monism (Davidson 1970). The problem of anomalism has a bit of an ironic history since the original intent of Davidson’s anomalous monism was to explain how mental causation is possible. Nonetheless, a number of critics have argued that anomalous monism leads to epiphenomenalism (Antony 1989, Kim 1989b, 1993c, LePore and Loewer 1987, McLaughlin 1989, 1993). Anomalous monism is made up of two theses: first, that there are no laws connecting mental properties with physical properties (this is the thesis called “psychophysical anomalism”), and second, that every mental event is token-identical with a physical event, and thus causally efficacious insofar as the physical event with which it is identical is causally efficacious. It is the result of the attempt to render consistent the following seemingly inconsistent set of statements:

Principle of Causal Interaction: at least some mental events interact causally with physical events.
Principle of Nomic Subsumption: events related as cause and effect fall under strict deterministic laws.
Principle of the Anomalism of the Mental: there are no strict deterministic laws on the basis of which mental events can be predicted and explained.

Each of these principles is independently plausible. The Principle of Causal Interaction is just the statement that mental causation occurs. The Principle of Nomic Subsumption needs a bit more explanation. This entry presents the most common reading of the principle. Suppose event c is of type F (it has F as a property) and e is of type G. According to this principle, F can be causally relevant to G only if there is a law is to the effect that events of type F cause events of type G. For instance, when a sudden sneeze causes a sleeping baby to awake, the cause has the capacity to produce that effect because there is a law-like generalization to the effect that noises above a certain level cause sleep disturbances. Davidson (1993) has objected to this construal of causation conflates causation with causal explanation. As Davidson explains, causal explanations mention properties when explaining a causal transaction, but statements reporting a causal transaction do not. When it comes to causation, events cause other events, according to Davidson, no matter how they are described – no matter which properties we refer to when talk about the events. This construal of causation has been roundly criticized (McLaughlin 1993).

The Principle of the Anomalism of the Mental states that there are no laws involving mental states that are strict, strict in the sense that they are exceptionless. A cursory look at the following generalizations reasonably backs this up:

If an agent desires p and believes that doing q can bring about p, then the agent will do q.
If an agent fears p, then the agent desires not-p.
If an agent wants p with all her heart, but discovers that not-p, then the agent will be disappointed that not-p.

(A) – (C) represent a very small number of generalizations of folk psychology, and while they do a good job of covering many cases, we can easily imagine circumstances under which they would be false. According to the Principle of the Anomalism of the Mental, this is true of all generalizations of folk psychology.

While independently plausible, the principles together appear to generate an inconsistency: if there are no laws couched in mental terms, as is maintained by the Anomalism of the Mental, but laws are necessary for causal interaction, which is stated by the Principle of Nomic Subsumption, then it follows that mental events have no causal powers, contrary to the first statement, the Principle of Causal Interaction. Davidson resolves this inconsistency with an appeal to token physicalism (explained above), where mental events can be causally efficacious, thanks to their token-identity with causally efficacious physical events.

Token physicalism, however, is not sufficient for supporting the causal relevance of mental properties – for securing the idea that a mental event caused a physical event in virtue of its having a mental property. In fact, the very argument Davidson gives for token physicalism through his argument for anomalous monism, has been interpreted to lead to the causal irrelevance of mental properties. The interpretation goes as follows: if event c can cause event e only if there is a strict law covering c and e, and the only laws that are strict are physical laws (laws relating physical properties) it follows that c causes e because of c‘s physical properties; indeed, c cannot cause e in virtue of its mental property, because mental properties cannot come together in a law. In short, if strict laws are necessary for securing the causal relevance of properties, but there are no strict laws involving mental properties, then mental properties cannot be relevant on this view.

1. The Appeal to Ceteris Paribus Laws

Ceteris Paribus Causal Relevance: A (mental) property M of an event c is causally relevant to a (physical) property P of event e if there is a strict causal law connecting M with P or a non-strict law connecting M with P.

Problems: This solution faces three objections. The first is that the ceteris paribus clauses may threaten to render any “law” vacuous that is so modified, and so strict laws might be what we need after all (Schiffer 1991, Fodor 1991b). The second is that mental properties just may not be the kinds of properties that can appear in laws, strict or otherwise. There are two considerations that have been availed in support of this skepticism. The first is based upon claims that normative relations constitutively constrain the distribution of mental properties, a pattern then cannot also be constrained by laws (Davidson 1970, 1974; McDowell 1984; Kim 1985). The second is based upon what is called the “simulation theory of folk psychology,” the idea that mental states are attributed to an agent by placing one’s self in the agent’s situation, a process that does not require the existence of mental laws (see Heal 1995, Gordon 1995, and Goldman 1995). The third objection is that even if mental properties can appear in laws, they face the problem of exclusion, which briefly is the problem that the physical properties of an event pre-empt its mental properties, given the generality of physics – that the physical domain is completely self-sufficient in bringing about all causal transactions – and the exclusion principle, which states that a causally sufficient property of an event excludes the causal relevance of other properties of the event.

2. The Appeal to Counterfactuals

The second solution to the problem of anomalism has been pursued by LePore and Loewer 1987, 1989, and Horgan 1989. Like the appeal to ceteris paribus laws, this approach also denies that strict laws are necessary for grounding the causal relevance of a property. But instead of appealing to non-strict laws, this solution appeals to counterfactual dependencies involving mental properties.

On this view, a mental property can be causally relevant if its non-occurrence means that the effect also would not have occurred. The basic idea is this. Suppose we want to know whether one’s belief that there is water in the glass was causally relevant to the motion of reaching out for the glass. The belief is causally relevant if the motion of reaching out would not have occurred if the belief had not occurred; this is just to say that the effect is counterfactually dependent upon its cause. Here is the account given by LePore and Loewer 1987:

Counterfactual Causal Relevance: Property M of event c is causally relevant to property P of event e if:

c causes e,

c has M and e has P,

if c did not have M, then e would not have had P,

M and P are metaphysically independent.

The appeal to causation in (i) does not render this partial analysis circular, since the analysis is for causal relevance, not causation per se. Condition (ii) highlights the role of properties in causal transactions. Condition (iii) states the counterfactual relation between the properties that allegedly suffices for one’s being causally relevant to the other. Condition (iv) comes from the Humean view that logically or metaphysically connected properties cannot stand in a causal relation, and so (iv) is to ensure that M and P are candidates for causal relevance.

Problem: The main problem with this solution is that the mere holding of the relevant counterfactuals is not sufficient for causal relevance (Braun 1995; McLaughlin 1989, p. 124; Kim 2006, pp. 189 – 194). Fires give off both heat and smoke. Now, if fire is placed near a piece of wax, the wax melts because of the heat, not the smoke, given off by the fire. That is, the smoke is not causally relevant to melting the wax. However, there is a counterfactual dependency of the melting upon the smoke because smoke, as much as heat, reliably occurs when there is fire. Thus, there are spurious counterfactual dependencies, and for all we know, the counterfactual dependency of bodily motion upon mental properties is as spurious as the dependency of melting upon smoke. The lesson is this: the counterfactual dependency of G upon F does not suffice for F’s causal relevance to G. In addition, the counterfactual approach also faces the problem of exclusion.

ii. Problem of Externalism

Externalism is a thesis about semantic content; according to the thesis, we must take into consideration facts about the physical environment, as well as the linguistic norms of one’s surrounding community, when individuating contentful mental states (the classic sources are Putnam 1975, Burge 1979). This is a thesis that affects intentional states (also called propositional attitudes), the states that have representational contents, rather than phenomenal states, the states that have a “what-it-is-like” quality to them. The problem generated by externalism for the causal relevance of intentional states is that it renders the content of the intentional state extrinsic (see Fodor 1987, pp. 27 – 54; McGinn 1989, p. 118). Causation, as we intuitively understand it, however, involves only the intrinsic features of objects and events. Consequently, externalist ways of individuating intentional content make them unsuitable for causal involvement.

While it is not easy to pin down exactly the distinction between intrinsic and extrinsic properties, we can get at the general idea with the following example. Take an individual who is 6 feet tall. Being 6 feet tall does not depend upon facts in its environment; whether or not the individual is tall or short, on the other, does so depend, since whether the individual is tall, say, will depend upon whether she is among small children. Properties that do not depend upon the environment are intrinsic; those that do are extrinsic.

To appreciate how causation only involves intrinsic properties, consider the following scenario. One puts a very convincing counterfeit dollar into a soda machine, successfully allowing you to get a soda. It is natural to assume that only the intrinsic features of the dollar bill – its size, design, texture – were causally relevant to the transaction, not the fact that the dollar is genuine or counterfeit, which are extrinsic features, as they involve a relation to certain facts, namely, where it was originally produced – at the U.S. mint or in one’s garage. These latter properties are extrinsic features of the dollar and the example illustrates their causal irrelevance.

Now, when we individuate the contents of a mental state (for those mental states that have intentional contents) according to standards of externalism, the content is rendered extrinsic. The classic example is found in Putnam (1975). Consider the very familiar term, “water.” The meaning of our term “water” is H2O. Now imagine a world, “Twin Earth,” that is just like ours except that the stuff the Twin Earthlings call “water” happens to be a different chemical compound, which we can just label “XYZ.” As Putnam argues, the meaning of “water” differs between the two worlds, even if Earthlings and Twin Earthlings make all the same associations with the stuff both call “water” – that it is stuff we drink, that it falls from the sky, fills the lakes and rivers, is the universal solvent, and so on. In spite of these identical associations, the word “water” is homonymous, meaning H2O when uttered by an Earthling, but XYZ when uttered by a Twin Earthling. This point about the meaning of the word transfers over to the content of our thoughts: when an Earthling and Twin-Earthling are entertaining thoughts about what both call “water,” they are thinking about different things.

This little scenario demonstrates how content – the meaning of the intentional state – under externalism, fails to supervene upon the individual’s internal properties, and is therefore extrinsic to the agent’s body. The threat of epiphenomenalism can be formulated thus:

Local Causation: A property F of an event c is causally relevant to property G of event e only if F is an intrinsic property of c.
Externalism: Intentional properties are not intrinsic properties of mental events.
——————————————————————-
Epiphenomenalism: Intentional properties are not causally relevant.

The problem is that extrinsic properties generally, as a rule, fail the test for causal relevance. As the test specified, a property can be causally relevant only if (among other things) had it failed to occur, the effect would not have occurred; and had it succeeded in occurring, then the effect would have occurred. But this pattern of counterfactual dependencies is not satisfied by externally individuated contents. Suppose you reach out for a refreshing glass of water because you believe that there is water in the glass. In order for that belief to be causally relevant, its absence must result in the absence of the reaching motion. But this isn’t what happens when we individuate content externally: the physical identical twin who is thinking about XYZ, not water proper, does exactly the same thing. Different thoughts do not manifest in different behaviors. As a result, content bearing mental states are not causally relevant to behavior.

1. The Appeal to Narrow Content (Internalism)

Solutions to the argument from externalism pursue one of two strategies; one is to deny the thesis of externalism, premise (2) (see Fodor 1980), and the other is to deny the thesis of local causation, premise (1) (see Burge 1995). Let us begin with the denial of externalism. The strategy here is to appeal to “narrow content.” Narrow content is the content that intrinsic twins have in common; narrow content, by stipulation, supervenes upon the intrinsic properties of an individual (Fodor 1991). (Think about the purely intrinsic features of the dollar bill – features that would be equally shared by a genuine bill and a counterfeit. The intrinsic features are their “narrow content.”) Unlike broad content, which is individuated in terms of the external, historical circumstances surrounding the uses of a term, narrow content is what supervenes upon the internal properties of the individuals, and is thus shared by you and your Twin-Earthly counterpart. Narrow content is the content one entertains under the Cartesian account of mental representation: as you entertain a thought of water, the content of that thought never “reaches out” beyond your head. Intentional properties, then, individuated narrowly, will be just as suited to causing behavior as any other internal properties of a person.

Problem: The appeal to narrow content certainly gets around the problem of causal irrelevance that faces broad content, but the notion of narrow content is highly contentious. Some have even argued that the notion is incoherent (see Adams et al. 1990). Consider again the counterfeit dollar. Surely we do not value it because just because it shares the same intrinsic features as the genuine article; the difference between the genuine bill and the counterfeit makes all the difference between the two. The relevance of the extrinsic is prevalent. Take a different case – the case of gold. When one wants to purchase a gold ring, one has in mind the metal with a certain molecular structure, not some alloy that looks like gold but isn’t gold. Our attributive practices honor this attention to the broad way of individuating content. When we refer to what people are thinking about, what the contents of their intentional states are, we intend to refer to the externalistically individuated contents of their mental states.

2. The Appeal to Wide Causation

The denial of the local causation thesis is the denial of the claim that only intrinsic properties of a cause can be causally relevant. The idea is that there can be “broad causation” (see Burge 1989, Yablo 1997). This view requires a little stage setting. On this approach, there is the causation of bodily motion by neural properties, on the one hand, and then there is the causation of intentionally characterized action by broadly individuated mental content. Take, for instance, one’s waving to a friend: by doing this, one performs the action of greeting a friend, but one also engages in a purely bodily process that engages one’s bones and muscles. On this solution to the problem of externalism, we have two causal processes – one that pertains to the proximal visual stimuli that result in the bodily movement – this would be “narrow causation” – and a different one that pertains to the appearance of the friend, resulting in the action of greeting – this would be “broad causation.” The friend one has in mind, of course, is the individual with whom one has had actual causal contact, not some physically similar but distinct individual (for example, an extraordinary gathering of molecular components that result in an object that looks like the friend). And to the extent that one has in mind the friend and not the freak doppelganger, one’s thought has broad content, which, on this approach, causally results in the action.

Problem: The very concept of wide causation goes against our ordinary intuitions about what causation involves. According to our ordinary intuitions, we assume that causes and their effects must be in spatial contact with each other or mediated by things that spatially link them together – that there is no action at a distance. But wide causation asks us to believe exactly this – that things are caused by situations that have no physical contact with them. It would make no difference, it seems, that it was the friend and not the doppelganger that motivated one to wave. For this reason, wide causation is not an easy solution (but see Yablo 1997 for a defense).

iii. Problem of Exclusion

It seems undeniable that mental states bring about behavior: it is because you wanted to catch the Frisbee that you sprung up to catch it – if you didn’t want to catch it, your body wouldn’t have moved the way it did. It is also undeniable that the brain, or more specifically, our neurophysiological system, is fully sufficient to bring about all bodily motion. There are many reasons, however, to think that mental states are not just mere states of the brain. But if this is the case, then it’s not clear what causal role mental states would have given that their neural correlates are fully equipped to perform all the causal work. Brain states, in other words, seem to make the mental states superfluous and therefore irrelevant.

The problem of exclusion can be laid out as follows (this formulation comes from Yablo 1992, pp. 247 – 248):

Exclusion: If a property F is causally sufficient for a property G, then no property distinct from F is causally relevant to G, barring overdetermination.
Closure: For every physical property P, there is a physical property P* that is causally sufficient for P.
Dualism: For every mental property M, M is distinct from P*.
—————————————————————–
Epiphenomenalism: For every physical property P, there is no mental property M that is causally sufficient for P.

The exclusion problem does not subscribe to any particular views about the nature of causation and its relationship to laws. Its standard formulations just invoke certain widely held physicalist principle that the physical world is causally closed and comprehensive. The simple reference to this principle, along with the assumption that mental properties are not reducible to physical properties, are all that’s needed to set the argument in motion. In addition, its epiphenomenalist conclusion applies not just to mental properties, but to any special science property that is not strictly reducible to a physical property. The argument casts a wide net (Kim 1989b, 1992, 1993b).

The following is a menu of the main strategies that have been pursued for solving the exclusion problem (see Kim 1989a, 1990 for a discussion of some of these options):

Reduction Strategy: For every mental property M, there is some physical property P with which M can be reductively identified.
Supervenience Strategy: Mental properties supervene upon physical properties, and supervening properties can be causally relevant if their base properties are causally relevant.
Realization Strategy: Mental properties are realized by physical properties, and mental properties are causally relevant if their realizing base properties are causally relevant.
Dual Explanandum Strategy: There are different ways to explain how M and P are causally relevant.

1. Reduction Strategy

There have been several proposals along these lines, none free of problems. On one approach, each mental property M is reductively identified with a physical property P. This is the view known as the Identity Theory of Mind, which was introduced by U.T. Place in 1956 and by J.J.C. Smart in 1956. The main problem with this approach is the multiple realizability of mental properties (Fodor 1975, 1980a, 1980b; Putnam 1960). According to this thesis, there are many different physical properties P1, P2, …, Pn, each of whose instantiation can suffice for the instantiation of its corresponding mental property M. If P1 and P2 are distinct realizers of M, then M cannot be identified with both P1 and P2. This makes sense if we think of the following example. Suppose Tom and Max are not the same height. Tom is, however, of the same height as Sally. If this is the case, then Sally cannot be the same height as both Tom and Max. The upshot is that no multiply realizable mental property is identifiable with, and hence, reducible to, a physical property.

On a different approach, which attempts to accommodate the multiple realizability of mental properties, known as disjunctive reduction, M is reduced to the disjunction of all the physical property realizations (P1 or P2 or … Pn), such that generalizations of the form

M if and only if (P1 or P2 or … Pn)

hold as a matter of law. The main problem with this approach is that it is committed to disjunctive properties whose disjuncts have nothing in common at the physical level. This makes the disjunct unsuitable for appearing in laws (Armstrong 1978, 1983).

On another approach, which also attempts to accommodate the multiple realizability of mental properties, known as species-specific or “local” reduction, M is reduced to a single physical kind P relative to some species S, giving us laws of the form

S only if (M if and only if P).

The problem with this approach is that it compromises the idea that a mental property is species-invariant – that a pain, say, in a human, is the same mental property as a pain in an octopus, a Martian, or a computer (see Pereboom and Kornblith 1991).

On another approach yet, it is not mental properties that are reduced per se, but rather their instances. Property instances are known as tropes. The idea here is that we can reduce an instance of a mental property – a mental trope – with a physical trope (see Macdonald and Macdonald 1986, Robb 1997). Tropes and properties differ in an important way: while a property is repeatable – whiteness, for instance, is one and the same entity that can appear in a multitude of different objects – a trope is not repeatable. The whiteness of a piece of paper, according to a trope theorist, is a unique instance of that particular shade of whiteness. The trope strategy is to identify a mental trope with a physical trope. The idea is that since physical tropes are causally relevant, identifying a mental trope with a physical trope secures its relevance as well. However, the trope approach is only as good as the argument for the claim that a mental trope is indeed identical with a physical trope. More problematically, there is a concern that we can ask even of tropes whether a trope is causally relevant in virtue of its being a mental trope as opposed to its being a physical trope. That is, the same underlying epiphenomenalist implications that plague Davidson’s token physicalism may be raised for the trope approach.

2. Supervenience Strategy

The most developed account under this option is given by Yablo (Yablo 1993). As scarlet and crimson are each determinates of the determinable red, M and P are related as determinable to determinate. Determinables supervene upon their determinates, and do so with metaphysical necessity. That is, there is no world in which the determinable does not appear if one of its determinates is instantiated.

Yablo argues that the virtue of this approach is that it does not pit M and P against each other as competitors, “since a determinate cannot pre-empt its own determinable.” (Yablo 1992, p. 250) So just as the determinate, crimson, does not causally pre-empt its determinable, red, when we all press our brake pedals at a traffic light that’s just turned crimson, no physical property P pre-empts the determinable mental property M when an agent performs an action.

Problem: While this approach has intuitive appeal, it is not clear that a determinate does not causally exclude the determinable. Consider the determinable, being colored, which has as its determinates, redness, yellowness, and greenness. The determinable is certainly present when any of these properties is present, but different effects ensue upon the instantiation of these properties. If, for instance, a driver detected a green light, she would have continued driving, but if she had detected a red light, she would have brought her car to a full stop. It appears that the determinable, being colored, was not relevant to either outcome since it was present with opposite outcomes.

3. Realization Strategy

Shoemaker 2001 appeals to the idea of realization, as it is implicated in the theory of functionalism and its attendant notion of multiple realizability, as well as a certain account of the nature of properties in general according to which properties are causal powers. (An earlier, but less developed, strategy along these lines is suggested by Kim 1993a.) On Shoemaker’s view, both realized and realizing properties have causal powers, but the causal powers of the realized (mental) property form a subset of the causal powers of the realizing (physical) property. The benefit of this view is that a subset of causal powers cannot be “excluded” or trumped or overridden by the superset, as the subset is just a part of the superset. If a 10-pound brick crushes a statue, then the part of the brick that weighs 8 pounds will certainly be involved in the effect, and not trumped by the 10-pound brick of which it constitutes a part.

Problem: Gillett and Rives 2005 argue that this account of realization does not safeguard mental properties from causal exclusion by their realizing physical properties. The idea is that if physical properties are fundamental and do all the causal work, then no property realized by a physical property does further causal work over and above the work done by the physical realizer. Claiming that the causal powers of a realized property form a subset of its realizing base does nothing to help the realized property enter into the causal work-force.

4. Dual Explanandum Strategy

Steuber 2005 argues that causation itself cannot be separated from the explanatory schemes in which they are expressed. Since psychological explanations accomplish one thing, while physical or neurobiological explanations accomplish another, the causal relations they track are themselves different relations, and thus not in competition with one another, as there is no one explanandum for them to both explain.

A strategy of this kind has been developed by Dretske (Dretske 1988, 1989). Dretske distinguishes between a triggering cause and a structuring cause, each cause satisfying two different types of explanatory interests. Schematically speaking, if we want to know how a particular behavior came about, we seek to isolate its triggering cause; such a cause lies within the purview of neurophysiological explanations. But if we want to know why an agent performed some particular behavior and not some other type of behavior, we are seeking its structuring cause, and these are the kinds of causes that psychological explanations are particularly well suited to picking out.

Dretske illustrates the difference between a triggering cause and a structuring cause, as well as how these causes are related to each other, with the homely thermostat. A thermostat is designed to turn on the furnace when it registers a certain temperature. The triggering cause of the switching of the furnace was the cool temperature of the room, but the wiring that connects the thermostat to the furnace, for instance, is the structuring cause of the very same effect. The structuring cause, in short, is the set of pre-existing background conditions that make it possible for the triggering cause to exert its particular effect. Most designed artifacts possess this sort of bi-level causal structure, and so do we. Just as a thermostat possesses an internal sensor calibrated to turn on the furnace when the sensor registers a certain temperature, we possess an internal representational system coordinated with our motor system to trigger the appropriate bodily movements when our internal states represent the presence of certain objects in the environment. Which connections are forged between a given representational state and its corresponding bodily motion, and how these connections are made, is largely a matter of the agent’s learning history. Learning is the process during which the representational content is “recruited” as a cause of the behavior; it structures, so to speak, the relevant links between the agent’s representational states and her motor output.

Problem: Kim 1989a, however, has objected that if we insist that a bit of behavior has some causal origin that is irreducibly mental, and therefore non-physical, then this effectively violates the causal closure of the physical domain. If not, then we are back to the very problem of exclusion that Dretske’s distinction was designed to avoid.

4. Conclusion: Where We are Now

Philosophers are still busy at work trying to make sense of mental causation. Many criticize the assumptions on which the alleged problems of mental causation are predicated, particularly Kim’s formulation of the exclusion problem (Bennett 2003, Menzies 2003, Raymont 2003). Others enjoin us to accept those very positions that have been cast aside as unavailable, such as type physicalism (Hill 1991), or down-right implausible, such as epiphenomenalism (Bieri 1992, Chalmers 1996, ch.5).

Some have even questioned whether we really have a problem concerning mental causation (Baker 1993, Burge 1993). Baker 1993 has argued that once the principles of physicalism are accepted, not only are we saddled with the exclusion problem, the problem is absolutely unsolvable. But, Baker continues, the wide-scale epiphenomenalism that would ensue were we to take the principles of physicalism seriously is tantamount to a reductio ad absurdum of the principles themselves, so we must reject the principles, in which case the exclusion problem dissolves of itself. Baker quite radically proposes that we reject the causal closure thesis if we wish to hold onto the possibility of mental causation – indeed, if we want to hold onto the possibility of macro-causation generally – a possibility that Baker claims is well testified by the successes of our explanatory practices.

Antony 1991 as well as Kim 1993, however, have argued that the problem of mental causation is the problem of explaining how and why there is this explanatory success when it comes to explaining behavior in mental terms. That is, the problem does not go away by pointing out that our mentalistic explanations perform quite well. The puzzle is how they explain so well, given that the metaphysics all point to the causal irrelevance of the mental.

There are, to be sure, other novel solutions in the making. But the ideal solution, given the multiplicity of the problems surrounding mental causation – the problem of anomalism, the problem of externalism, and the problem of exclusion – is one that can solve all the problems together, perhaps not with just one account that simultaneously solves all three, but maybe a patchwork account, each of whose components mutually support the others.

5. References and Further Reading

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Anscombe, E. and Geach, P. (1954), Descartes: Philosophical Writings, Indianapolis: Bobbs-Merrill Company.
Antony, L. (1989), “Anomalous Monism and the Problem of Explanatory Force,” The Philosophical Review 98: 153-87.
Antony, L. (1991), “The Causal Relevance of the Mental: More on the Mattering of Minds,” Mind and Language, 6: 295-327.
Armstrong, D., (1978), Universals and Scientific Realism, Vol. I, A Theory of Universals, Vol. II, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Armstrong, D, (1983), What is a Law of Nature? Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Aronson, J. (1971), “On the Grammar of ‘Cause’,” Synthese 22: 414-430.
Baker, L. (1993), “Metaphysics and Mental Causation,” in Heil and Mele (1993): 75-95.
Bieri, P. (1992), “Trying out epiphenomenalism” Erkenntnis 36, 283-309.
Braun, D. (1995) “Causally Relevant Properties.” Philosophical Perspectives 9: 447-75.
Burge, T. (1986), “Individualism and Psychology,” Philosophical Review, 95: 3-46.
Burge, T. (1993), “Mind-Body Causation and Explanatory Practice,” in Heil and Mele (1993): 97-120.
Burge, T. (1989), “Individuation and Causation in Psychology,” Pacific Philosophical Quarterly, 70: 303-322.
Byrne, A., 1993, The Emergent Mind, Ph.D. Dissertation. Princeton.
Chalmers, D. (1996), The Conscious Mind: In Search of a Fundamental Theory, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Child, W. (1994). “Anomalism, uncodifiability, and psychophysical relations.” Philosophical Review, 102: 215-245.
Churchland, P. (1981), “Eliminativist Materialism and the Propositional Attitudes,” in Journal of Philosophy 78: 67-90.
Cottingham, J., Stoothoff, R., Murdoch, D., eds., (1984), The Philosophical Writings of Descartes, vol. 2, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press
Davidson, D. (1970), “Mental Events,” reprinted in Davidson (1980): 207-227.
Davidson, D. (1974), “Psychology as Philosophy,” reprinted in Davidson (1980): 229-44.
Davidson, D. (1980), Essays on Actions and Events, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
Davidson, D. (1993), “Thinking Causes,” reprinted in Heil and Mele (1993): 3-17.
Davies, M., and Stone, T., (1995), Folk Psychology: The Theory of Mind Debate, Oxford: Blackwell Press.
Dowe, P. (2000), Physical Causation, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Dretske, F. (1989), “Reasons and Causes,” Philosophical Perspectives, 3: 1-15.
Dretske, F. (1993), “Mental Events as Structuring Causes of Behavior,” in Heil and Mele (1993): 121-136.
Fair, D. (1979), “Causation and the Flow of Energy,” Erkenntnis 14, 219-250.
Fodor, J. (1975), The Language of Thought. New York: Thomas Crowell.
Fodor, J. (1980), Representations: Philosophical Essays on the Foundations of Cognitive Science, Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Fodor, J. 1980b), “Methodological Solipsism Considered as a Research Strategy in Cognitive Science,” The Behavioral and Brain Sciences 3: 63-109. Also reprinted in Fodor (1980).
Fodor, J. (1980a), “Special Sciences,” in Fodor (1980).
Fodor, J. (1989), “Making Mind Matter More,” Philosophical Topics, 17: 59-80.
Fodor, J. (1987), Psychosemantics, Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Fodor, J., (1991a), “A Modal Argument for Narrow Content,” Journal of Philosophy 88: 5-26.
Fodor, J. (1991b), “You Can Fool Some of the People All the Time, Everything Else Being Equal; Hedged Laws and Psychological Explanations,” Mind, 100: 19-33.
Gillett, C. (2002), “The Dimensions of Realization: A Critique of the Standard View,” Analysis, 62: 316-323.
Gillett, Carl, and Barry Loewer (eds.). (2001) Physicalism and Its Discontents, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Gillett, C. and Rives, Bradley (2005), “The Non-Existence of Determinables: Or, a World of Absolute Determinates as a Default Hypothesis,” Nous, 39, pp. 483-504.
Goldman, A. (1995), “Interpretation Psychologized,” in M. Davies and T. Stone, (eds.) (1995).
Gordon, R., (1995), “The Simulation Theory: Objections and Misconceptions,” in M. Davies and T. Stone, (eds.) (1995).
Heal, J. (1995), “Replication and Functionalism,” in M. Davies and T. Stone, (eds.) (1995).
Heil, J. and Mele, A. (1993) (eds.), Mental Causation, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
Hellman, G., and Thompson, F. (1975), “Physicalism: Ontology, Determination, Reduction,” Journal of Philosophy, 72: 551-64.
Hill, C. (1991). Sensations: A Defense of Type Materialism. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Horgan, T. (1989), “Mental Quausation,” Philosophical Perspectives 3: 47-76.
Jackson, F. (1982), “Epiphenomenal Qualia,” Philosophical Quarterly 32: 127-36.
Kim, J. (1984a), “Concepts of Supervenience,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 65: 153-76.
Kim, J. (1984b), “Epiphenomenal and Supervenient Causation,” Midwest Studies in Philosophy, 4: 31-49.
Kim, J. (1985), “Psychophysical Laws,” in LePore and McLaughlin (1985): 369-86.
Kim, J. (1989a), “Mechanism, Purpose and Explanatory Exclusion,” Philosophical Perspectives, 3: 77-108.
Kim, J. (1989b), “The Myth of Nonreductive Materialism,” Proceedings of the American Philosophical Association, 63: 31-47, reprinted in Kim (1993).
Kim, J. (1990), “Explanatory Exclusion and the Problem of Mental Causation,” in Villanueva (1990): 36-56.
Kim, J. (1993), Supervenience and Mind, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Kim, J. (1993a), “Multiple Realization and the Metaphysics of Reduction,” in Kim (1993): 309-35.
Kim, J. (1993b), “Postscripts on Mental Causation,” in Kim (1993): 358-67.
Kim, J. (1993c), “The Non-Reductivist’s Trouble With Mental Causation,” in Heil and Mele (1993): 189-210.
Kim, J. (2005), Physicalism, or Something Near Enough. Princeton University Press.
Kim, J. (2006), Philosophy of Mind, 2nd edition, Cambridge MA: Westview Press.
Kripke, S. (1980), Naming and Necessity, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
Kripke, S. (1982), Wittgenstein on Rule-Following and Private Language, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
Leibniz, G.W. (1695), “New System of the Nature of Substances and their Communication, and of the Union Which exists Between the Soul and the Body,” reprinted in G.W. Leibniz: Philosophical Texts, eds. R.S. Woolhouse and R. Franks, (1998), Oxford: Oxford University Press, 143-152.
LePore, E., Lower, B. (1987), “Mind Matters,” Journal of Philosophy, 84: 630-42.
LePore, E., Lower, B. (1989), “More on Making Mind Matter,” Philosophical Topics, 17: 175-91.
LePore, E., McLaughlin, B. (1985) (eds.), Actions and Events: Perspective on the Philosophy of Donald Davidson, Oxford: Basil Blackwell.
Lewis, D. (1983), “New Work for a Theory of Universals?” Australasian Journal of Philosophy, 61: 343-77.
Macdonald, C., Macdonald, G. (1986), “Mental Causes and Explanation of Action,” The Philosophical Quarterly, 36: 145-58.
Malebranche, N. (1958) Oeuvres complètes de Malebranche, A. Robinet, ed., Paris: J. Vrin.
McDowell, J. (1984), “Functionalism and Anomalous Monism,” in LePore and McLaughlin (1985): 387-98.
McGinn, C. (1989), Mental Content, Oxford: Blackwell Press.
McLaughlin, B. (1989), “Type Epiphenomenalism, Type Dualism, and the Causal Priority of the Physical,” Philosophical Perspectives, 3: 109-35.
McLaughlin, B. (1993), “On Davidson’s Response to the Charge of Epiphenomenalism,” in Heil and Mele (1993): 27-40.
McLaughlin, B. (1995), “Varieties of Supervenience,” in E. Savellos and Umit D. Yalcin, eds., (1995).
Melnyk, A. (2003), A Physicalist Manifesto: Thoroughly Modern Materialism. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Nagel, T. (1974), “What Is It Like to Be a Bat?,” Philosophical Review 83: 435-50.
Poland, J. 1994. Physicalism: The Empirical Foundations. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Putnam, H. (1960), “Minds and Machines,” in Mind, Language and Reality: Philosophical Papers 2, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Putnam, H. (1979), Mind, Language and Reality: Philosophical Papers 2, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Putnam, H. (1975), “The Meaning of ‘Meaning’,” in Putnam (1979): 215-71.
Robb, D. (1997), “The Properties of Mental Causation,” Philosophical Quarterly 47: 178-94.
Robinet, A. (1958) (ed.) Oeuvres complètes de Malebranche, Paris: J. Vrin.
Salmon, W. (1994), “Causality Without Counterfactuals,” Philosophy of Science 61, 297-312.
Savellos, E., and Yalcin, U.D., (1995), Supervenience: New Essays, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Schiffer, S. (1991), “Ceteris Paribus Laws,” Mind, 100: 1-17.
Shoemaker, Sydney. (2001), “Realization and Mental Causation,” in Gillett and Loewer (eds.), pp. 74-98.
Stoljar, D., 2001, “Two Conceptions of the Physical,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 62: 253-81.
Stueber, K. (2005), “Mental Causation and the Paradoxes of Explanation,” Philosophical Studies 122: 243-77.
Woolhouse, R.S., and Franks, R. (1998) (eds.), G.W. Leibniz: Philosophical Texts, eds. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 143-152.
Yablo, S. (1992), “Mental Causation,” The Philosophical Review, 101: 245-280.

Author Information

Julie Yoo
Email: julie.yoo@csun.edu
California State University at Northridge
U. S. A.

William of Ockham (Occam, c. 1280—c. 1349)

William of Ockham, also known as William Ockham and William of Occam, was a fourteenth-century English philosopher. Historically, Ockham has been cast as the outstanding opponent of Thomas Aquinas (1224-1274): Aquinas perfected the great “medieval synthesis” of faith and reason and was canonized by the Catholic Church; Ockham destroyed the synthesis and was condemned by the Catholic Church. Although it is true that Aquinas and Ockham disagreed on most issues, Aquinas had many other critics, and Ockham did not criticize Aquinas any more than he did others. It is fair enough, however, to say that Ockham was a major force of change at the end of the Middle Ages. He was a courageous man with an uncommonly sharp mind. His philosophy was radical in his day and continues to provide insight into current philosophical debates.

The principle of simplicity is the central theme of Ockham’s approach, so much so that this principle has come to be known as “Ockham’s Razor.” Ockham uses the razor to eliminate unnecessary hypotheses. In metaphysics, Ockham champions nominalism, the view that universal essences, such as humanity or whiteness, are nothing more than concepts in the mind. He develops an Aristotelian ontology, admitting only individual substances and qualities. In epistemology, Ockham defends direct realist empiricism, according to which human beings perceive objects through “intuitive cognition,” without the help of any innate ideas. These perceptions give rise to all of our abstract concepts and provide knowledge of the world. In logic, Ockham presents a version of supposition theory to support his commitment to mental language. Supposition theory had various purposes in medieval logic, one of which was to explain how words bear meaning. Theologically, Ockham is a fideist, maintaining that belief in God is a matter of faith rather than knowledge. Against the mainstream, he insists that theology is not a science and rejects all the alleged proofs of the existence of God. Ockham’s ethics is a divine command theory. In the Euthyphro dialogue, Plato (437-347 B.C.E.) poses the following question: Is something good because God wills it or does God will something because it is good? Although most philosophers affirm the latter, divine command theorists affirm the former. Ockham’s divine command theory can be seen as a consequence of his metaphysical libertarianism. In political theory, Ockham advances the notion of rights, separation of church and state, and freedom of speech.

Life and Works
The Razor
Metaphysics: Nominalism
Epistemology
1. Direct Realist Empiricism
2. Intuitive Cognition
Logic
Theology
1. Fideism
2. Against the Proofs of God’s Existence
  1. The Ontological Proof
  2. The Cosmological Proof
Ethics
1. Divine Command Theory
2. Metaphysical Libertarianism
Political Theory
References and Further Reading

1. Life and Works

Very little biographical information about Ockham survives. There is a record of his ordination in the year 1306. From this, we infer that he was born between 1280 and 1285, presumably in the small town of Ockham, twenty-five miles southwest of London, England. The medieval church in this town, All Saints, recently installed a stained glass window of Ockham because it is probably the church in which he grew up. Nevertheless, we know nothing of Ockham’s childhood or family. Most likely, he spoke Middle English and wrote exclusively in Latin.

Because Ockham joined the Franciscan order (known as the Order of the Friars Minor or OFM), he would have received his early education at a Franciscan house. From there, he pursued a degree in theology at Oxford University. He never completed it, however, because in 1323 he was summoned to the papal court, which had been moved from Rome to Avignon, to answer to charges of heresy.

Ockham remained in Avignon under a loose form of house arrest for four years while the papacy carried out its investigation. Through this ordeal Ockham became convinced that the papacy was corrupt and finally decided to flee with some other Franciscans on trial there. On May 26, 1328 they escaped in the night on stolen horses to the court of Louis of Bavaria, a would-be emperor, who had his own reasons for opposing the Pope. They were all ex-communicated and hunted down but never captured.

After a brief and unsuccessful campaign in Italy, Louis and his entourage settled in Munich. Ockham spent the rest of his days there as a political activist, writing treatises against the papacy. Ockham died sometime between 1347 and 1349, unreconciled with the Catholic Church. Because he never returned to his academic career, Ockham acquired the nickname “Venerable Inceptor”—an “inceptor” being one who is on the point of earning a degree. Ockham’s other nickname is the “More than Subtle Doctor” because he was thought to have surpassed the Franciscan philosopher John Duns Scotus (1265/6-1308), who was known as the Subtle Doctor.

Methodologically, Ockham fits comfortably within the analytic philosophical tradition. He considers himself a devoted follower of Aristotle (384-322 B.C.E.), whom he calls “The Philosopher,” though most Aristotle scholars would find many of his interpretations dubious. Ockham may simply have a unique understanding of Aristotle or he may be using Aristotle as cover for developing views he knew would be threatening to the status quo.

Aside from Aristotle, the French Franciscan philosopher Peter John Olivi (1248 – 1298) was the single most important influence on Ockham. Olivi is an extremely original thinker, pioneering direct realism, nominalism, metaphysical libertarianism, and many of the same political views that Ockham defends later in his career. One notable difference between the two, however, is that, while Ockham loves Aristotle, Olivi hates him. Ockham never acknowledges Olivi because Olivi was condemned as a heretic.

Ockham published several philosophical works before losing official status as an academic. The first was his Commentary on the Sentences of Peter Lombard, a standard requirement for medieval theology students. The philosopher and archbishop Peter Lombard (1100–1160/4) composed a book of opinions (sententia) for and against various controversial claims. By commenting on this book, students would learn the art of argumentation while at the same time developing their own views. As a student, Ockham also wrote several commentaries on the works of Aristotle. In addition, he engaged in public debates, the proceedings of which were published under the titles Disputed Questions and Quodlibetal Questions—“quodlibet” meaning “whatever you like.” Ockham’s opus magnum, however, is his Suma Logicae, in which he lays out the fundamentals of his logic and its accompanying metaphysics. We do not know exactly when it was written, but it is the latest of his academic works. After the Avignon affair, Ockham wrote and circulated several political treatises unofficially, the most important of which is his Dialogue on the Power of the Emperor and the Pope. All of Ockham’s works have been edited into modern editions but not all have been translated.

2. The Razor

Ockham’s Razor is the principle of parsimony or simplicity according to which the simpler theory is more likely to be true. Ockham did not invent this principle; it is found in Aristotle, Aquinas, and other philosophers Ockham read. Nor did he call the principle a “razor.” In fact, the first known use of the term “Occam’s razor” occurs in 1852 in the work of the British mathematician William Rowan Hamilton. Although Ockham never even makes an argument for the validity of the principle, he uses it in many striking ways, and this is how it became associated with him.

For some, the principle of simplicity implies that the world is maximally simple. Aquinas, for example, argues that nature does not employ two instruments where one suffices. This interpretation of the principle is also suggested by its most popular formulation: “Entities should not be multiplied beyond necessity.” Yet this is a problematic assertion. We know today that nature is often redundant in both form and function. Although medieval philosophers were largely ignorant of evolutionary biology, they did affirm the existence of an omnipotent God, which is alone enough to render the assumption that the world is maximally simple suspicious. In any case, Ockham never makes this assumption and he does not use the popular formulation of the principle.

For Ockham, the principle of simplicity limits the multiplication of hypotheses not necessarily entities. Favoring the formulation “It is useless to do with more what can be done with less,” Ockham implies that theories are meant to do things, namely, explain and predict, and these things can be accomplished more effectively with fewer assumptions.

At one level, this is just common sense. Suppose your car suddenly stops running and your fuel gauge indicates an empty gas tank. It would be silly to hypothesize both that you are out of gas and that you are out of oil. You need only one hypothesis to explain what has happened.

Some would object that the principle of simplicity cannot guarantee truth. The gas gauge on your car may be broken or the empty gas tank may be just one of several things wrong with the car. In response to this objection, one might point out that the principle of simplicity does not tell us which theory is true but only which theory is more likely to be true. Moreover, if there is some other sign of damage, such as a blinking oil gage, then there is a further fact to explain, warranting an additional hypothesis.

Although the razor seems like common sense in everyday situations, when used in science, it can have surprising and powerful effects. For example, in his classic exposition of theoretical physics, A Brief History of Time, Stephen Hawking attributes the discovery of quantum mechanics to Ockham’s Razor.

Nevertheless, not everyone approves of the razor. Ockham’s contemporary and fellow Franciscan Walter Chatton proposed an “anti-razor” in opposition to Ockham. He declares that if three things are not enough to verify an affirmative proposition about things, a fourth must be added, and so on. Others call Ockham’s razor a “principle of stinginess,” accusing it of quashing creativity and imagination. Still others complain that there is no objective way to determine which of two theories is simpler. Often a theory that is simpler in one way is more complicated in another way. All of these concerns and others make Ockham’s razor controversial.

At bottom, Ockham advocates simplicity in order to reduce the risk of error. Every hypothesis carries the possibility that it may be wrong. The more hypotheses you accept, the more you increase your risk. Ockham strove to avoid error at all times, even if it meant abandoning well-loved, traditional beliefs. This approach helped to earn him his reputation as destroyer of the medieval synthesis of faith and reason.

3. Metaphysics: Nominalism

One of the most basic challenges in metaphysics is to explain how it is that things are the same despite differences. The Greek philosopher Heraclitus (540 – 480 B.C.E.) points out that you can never step into the same river twice, referring not just to rivers, but to places, people, and life itself. Every day everything changes a little bit and everywhere you go you find new things. Heraclitus concludes from such observations that nothing ever remains the same. All reality is in flux.

The problem with seeing the world this way is that it leads to radical skepticism: if nothing stays the same from moment to moment and from place to place, then we can never really be certain about anything. We can’t know our friends, we can’t know the world we live in, we can’t even know ourselves! Moreover, if Heraclitus is right, it seems science is impossible. We could learn the properties of a chemical here today and still have no basis for knowing its properties someplace else tomorrow.

Needless to say, most people would prefer to avoid skepticism. It’s hard to carry on in a state of complete ignorance. Besides, it seems obvious that science is not impossible. Studying the world really does enable us to know how things are over time and across distances. The fact that things change through time and vary from place to place does not seem to prevent us from having knowledge. From this, some philosophers, such as Plato and Augustine (354-430), draw the conclusion that Heraclitus was wrong to suppose that everything is in flux. Something stays the same, something that lays underneath the changing and varying surfaces we perceive, namely, the universal essence of things.

For example, although individual human beings change from day to day and vary from place to place, they all share the universal essence of humanity, which is eternally the same. Likewise for dogs, trees, rocks, and even qualities—there must be a universal essence of blueness, heat, love, and anything else one can think of. Universal essences are not physical realities; if you dissect a human being, you will not find humanity inside like a kidney or a lung! Nevertheless, universal essences are metaphysical realities: they provide the invisible structure of things.

Belief in universal essences is called “metaphysical realism,” because it asserts that universal essences are real even though we cannot physically see them. Although there are various different versions of metaphysical realism, they are all designed to secure a foundation for knowledge. It seems you have a choice: either you accept metaphysical realism or you are stuck with skepticism.

Ockham, however, argues that this is a false dilemma. He rejects metaphysical realism and skepticism in favor of nominalism: the view that universal essences are concepts in the mind. The word “nominalism” comes from the Latin word nomina, meaning name. Earlier nominalists such as the French philosopher Roscelin (1050-1125), had advanced the more radical view that universal essences are just names that have no basis in reality. Ockham developed a more sophisticated version of nominalism often called “conceptualism” because it holds that universal essences are concepts caused in our minds when we perceive real similarities among things in the world.

For example, when a child comes in contact with different human beings over time, he begins to form the concept of humanity. The realist would say that he has detected the invisible common structure of these individuals. Ockham, in contrast, insists that the child has merely perceived similarities that fit naturally under one concept.

It is tempting to assume that Ockham rejects metaphysical realism because of the principle of simplicity. After all, realism requires believing in invisible entities that might not actually exist. As a matter of fact, however, Ockham never uses the razor to attack realism. And on closer examination, this makes sense: the realist position is that the existence of universal essences is a hypothesis necessary to explain how science is possible. Since Ockham was just as concerned as everyone else to avoid skepticism, he might have been persuaded by such an argument.

Ockham has a much deeper worry about realism: he is convinced it is incoherent. Incoherence is the most serious charge a philosopher can level against a theory because it means that the theory contains a contradiction—and contradictions cannot be true. Ockham asserts that metaphysical realism cannot be true because it holds that a universal essence is one thing and many things at the same time. The form of humanity is one thing, because it is what all humans have in common, but it is also many things because it provides an invisible structure of each individual one of us. This is to say that it is both one thing and not one thing at the same time, which is a contradiction.

Realists claim that this apparent contradiction can be explained in various ways. Ockham insists, however, that no matter how you explain it, there is no way to avoid the fact that the notion of a universal essence is an impossible hypothesis. He writes,

There is no universal outside the mind really existing in individual substances or in the essences of things…. The reason is that everything that is not many things is necessarily one thing in number and consequently a singular thing. [Opera Philosophica II, pp. 11-12]

Ockham presents a thought experiment to prove universal essences do not exist. He writes that, according to realism,

…it would follow that God would not be able to annihilate one individual substance without destroying the other individuals of the same kind. For, if he were to annihilate one individual, he would destroy the whole that is essentially that individual and, consequently, he would destroy the universal that is in it and in others of the same essence. Other things of the same essence would not remain, for they could not continue to exist without the universal that constitutes a part of them. [Opera Philosophica I, p. 51]

Since God is omnipotent, he should be able to annihilate a human being. But the universal form of humanity lies within that human being. So, by destroying the individual, he will destroy the universal. And if he destroys the universal, which is humanity, then he destroys all the other humans as well.

The realist may wish to reply that destroying an individual human destroys only part of the universal humanity. But this contradicts the original assertion that the universal humanity is a single shared essence that is eternally the same for everyone! For Ockham, this problem decisively defeats realism and leaves us with the nominalist alternative that universals are concepts caused in our minds when we perceive similar individuals. To support this alternative, Ockham develops an empiricist epistemology.

4. Epistemology

a. Direct Realist Empiricism

Epistemology is the study of knowledge: what is it, and how do we come to have it? There are two basic approaches to epistemology: rationalists claim that knowledge consists of innate certainties that we discover through reason; empiricists claim that knowledge consists in accurate perceptions that we accumulate through experience. Although early medieval philosophers such as Augustine and Anselm (1033-1109) were innatists, empiricism came to dominate during the high Middle Ages. This is mostly because Aristotle was an empiricist and the texts in which he promotes empiricism were rediscovered and translated for the first time into Latin during the thirteenth century.

Following Aristotle, Ockham asserts that human beings are born blank states: there are no innate certainties to be discovered in our minds. We learn by observing qualities in objects. Ockham’s version of empiricism is called “direct realism” because he denies that there is any intermediary between the perceiver and the world. (Note that direct realism should not be confused with metaphysical realism, which Ockham rejects, as discussed above.) Direct realism states that if you see an apple, its redness causes you to know that it is red. This may seem obvious, but it actually raises a problem that has led many empiricists, both in Ockham’s day and today, to reject direct realism.

As the French philosopher Peter Aureol (1275-1333) points out, the problem is that there are cases where we perceive something that is not really there. In optical illusions, hallucinations, and dreams, our perceptions are completely disconnected with the external world.

Representationalism is the version of empiricism designed to solve this problem. According to representationalists, human beings perceive the world through a mental mediary, or representation, known in the Middle Ages as the “intelligible species.” Normally, an apple causes an intelligible species of itself for us to perceive it through. In cases of optical illusions, hallucinations, and dreams, something else causes the intelligible species. The perception seems veridical to us because there is no difference in the intelligible species. Even before Peter Aureol, Thomas Aquinas advocated representationalism, and it soon became the dominant view.

The difficulty with representationalism, as the Irish philosopher George Berkeley (1685-1754) amply demonstrates, is that once you introduce an intermediary between the perceiver and the external world, you lose your justification for belief in the external world. If all of our ideas come through representations, how do we know what, if anything, is behind these representations? Something other than physical objects could be causing them. For example, God could be transmitting representations of physical objects to our minds without ever creating any physical objects at all—which is in fact what Berkeley came to believe. This view, known as idealism, is radically skeptical, and most philosophers prefer to avoid it.

b. Intuitive Cognition

Ockham preempts idealism through the notion of intuitive cognition, which plays a crucial role in his four-step account of knowledge acquisition. It can be summarized as follows. The first step is sensory cognition: receiving data through the five senses. This is an ability human beings share with animals. The second step, intuitive cognition, is uniquely human. Intuitive cognition is an awareness that the particular individual perceived exists and has the qualities it has. The third step is recordative cognition, by which we remember past perceptions. The fourth step is abstractive cognition, by which we place individuals in groups of similar individuals.

Notice that, if an apple is set in front of a horse, the horse will receive data about the apple—the color, the smell, etc.—and react appropriately. The horse will not, however, register the reality of the object. Suppose you project a realistic, laser image of an apple in front of the horse and he tries to take a bite. He will become frustrated, and eventually give up, but he will never really “get it.” Human beings, in contrast, have reality-sensitive minds. It’s not a matter of thinking “This is real” every time we see something. On the contrary, Ockham asserts that intuitive cognition is non-propositional. Rather, it is a matter of registering that the apple really has the qualities we perceive. Ockham writes:

Intuitive cognition is such that when some things are cognized, of which one inheres in the other, or one is spatially distant from the other, or exists in some relation to the other, immediately in virtue of that non-propositional cognition of those things, it is known if the thing inheres or does not inhere, if it is spatially distant or not, and the same for other true contingent propositions, unless that cognition is flawed or there is some impediment. [Opera Theologica I, p. 31]

While intuitive cognition is itself non-propositional, it provides the basis for formulating true propositions. A horse cannot say “This apple is red” because its mind is not complex enough to register the reality of what it perceives. The human mind, registering the existence of things—both that they are and how they are—can therefore formulate assertions about them.

Strictly speaking, when one has an intuitive cognition of an apple, one is not yet thinking of it as an apple, because this requires placing it in a group. In normal adult human perception, all four of the above steps happen together so quickly that it is hard to separate them. But try to imagine what perception is like for a toddler: she sees the round, red object and points to it saying “That!” This is an expression of intuitive cognition.

Intuitive cognition secures a causal link between the external world and the human mind. The human mind is entirely passive, according to Ockham, during intuitive cognition. Objects in the world cause us to be aware of their existence, and this explains and justifies our belief in them.

Despite his insistence on the causal link between the world and our minds, Ockham clearly recognizes cases in which intuitive cognition causes false judgment. (See the last line of the above quotation: “…unless that cognition is flawed or there is some impediment.”) For example, when you see a stick half-emerged in water, it looks bent. This is because your intuitive cognition of the stick is being affected by your simultaneous intuitive cognition of the water, and this causes a skewed perception. In addition to leaving room for error on his account, Ockham also leaves room for skepticism: God can transmit representations to human beings that seem exactly like intuitive cognitions.

Given that direct realism cannot rule out skepticism any more than representationalism can, one might wonder why Ockham prefers it. In the end, it is a question of simplicity. Whereas Ockham never uses his razor against metaphysical realism, he does use it against representationalism. Intuitive cognition is necessary to secure a causal link between the world and the mind, and, once it is in place, there is no need for a middle man. The intelligible species is an unnecessary hypothesis.

It is worth noting that intuitive cognition also provides epistemological support for Ockham’s nominalist metaphysics. Representationalists typically hold that the intelligible species emanates from the universal essence of the thing. In their view, you perceive an apple as an apple because the apple’s universal essence of appleness is conveyed to you through its intelligible species. In fact, many metaphysical realists would argue for the superiority of their view precisely on the grounds that universal essences provide a basis for intelligible species, and intelligible species are necessary for us to know what we are perceiving. They would ask: how else do we ever identify apples as apples instead of just so many distinct individuals?

As we have seen, Ockham argues that there is no universal essence. There is therefore no basis for an intelligible species. Each object in the world is an absolute individual and that is how we perceive it at first. Just like toddlers, we are bombarded with a buzzing, booming confusion of colors and sounds. But our minds are powerful sorting machines. We remember perceptions over time (recordative cognition) and organize them into groups (abstractive cognition). This organizational process gives us a coherent understanding of the world and is what Ockham aims to explain in his account of logic.

5. Logic

a. Mentalese

Although the human mind is born without any knowledge, according to Ockham, it does come fully equip with a system for processing perceptions as they are acquired. This system is thought, which Ockham understands in terms of an unspoken, mental language. He is therefore considered an advocate of “mentalese,” like the American philosopher Noam Chomsky.

Ockham might compare thought to a machine ready to manipulate a vast quantity of empty boxes. As we observe the world, perceptions are placed in the empty boxes. Then the machine sorts and organizes the boxes according to content. Two small boxes with similar contents might be placed together in a big box, and then the big box might be conjoined to another big box. For example, as perceptions of Rover and Fido accumulate, they become the concept dog, and then the concept dog is associated with the concept fleas. This conceptual apparatus enables us to construct meaningful sentences, such as “All dogs have fleas.”

The intuitive cognition in Ockham’s epistemology provides a basis for what is today called a “causal theory of reference” in philosophy of language. The word “dog” means dog because the concept you think of when you write it or say it was caused by the dogs you have perceived. Dogs cause the same kinds of concepts in all human beings. Thus, mentalese is universal among us, even though there are different ways to speak and write words in different countries around the world. While written and spoken language is conventional, signification itself is natural.

Early in his career, Ockham entertained the notion that concepts are mental objects or “ficta” which resemble objects in the world like pictures. He abandoned ficta theory, however, because it presupposes a representationalist epistemology, which in turn presupposes metaphysical realism. Arguing instead for “intellectum theory,” according to which objects can have causal impact on the mind without creating mental pictures of themselves; he offers the following analogy. Medieval pubs received wine in shipments of wooden barrels sealed with hoops. When the shipment arrived, the pub owner would hang a barrel hoop outside the front door to communicate to the townspeople that wine was available. Although the hoop did not resemble wine in any way, it was significant to the townspeople. This is because the presence of the hoop was caused by the arrival of the wine. Likewise, dogs in the world cause concepts in our minds that are significant even though they do not resemble dogs.

It must be noted that there is a drawback to both the barrel hoop analogy and the box illustration: they portray concepts as things. For convenience, Ockham often speaks of concepts loosely as though they were things. However, according to intellectum theory, concepts are not really things at all but rather actions. Perceiving a dog does not cause an entity to exist in your mind; rather, it causes a mental act. Today we would say that it causes a neuron to fire. Repeated acts cause a habit: the disposition to perform the act at will. So, repeated perceptions of dogs cause repeated acts of dog-conceiving and those repeated acts cause a dog-conceiving habit, meaning that you can engage in dog-conceiving actions whenever you want, even when there are no dogs around to perceive.

b. Supposition Theory

In Ockham’s view, any coherent thought we have requires connecting or disconnecting concepts by means of linguistic operators. Ockham has a lot of ideas about how the linguistic operators work, which he develops in his version of supposition theory. Although supposition theory was a major preoccupation of late medieval logicians, scholars are still divided over its purpose. Some think it was an effort to build a system of formal logic that ultimately failed. Others think it was more akin to a modern theory of logical form.

Ockham’s interest in supposition theory seems motivated by his concern to clarify conceptual confusion. Much like Ludwig Wittgenstein (1889-1951), Ockham asserts that many philosophical errors arise due to the misunderstanding of language. He took metaphysical realism to be a prime example. Conceiving of human beings in general leads us to use the word “humanity.” Metaphysical realists conclude that this word must refer to a universal essence within all human beings. For Ockham, however, the word “humanity” stands for a habit that enables us to conceive of all the human beings we have perceived to date in a very efficient manner: stripped of all of their individual details. In this way, Ockham’s supposition theory is designed to support his nominalist metaphysics while elucidating the rules of thought.

The word “supposition” comes from the Latin word “stand for” but it closely approximates the technical notion known as “reference” in English. At its most basic level, supposition theory tells us how words used in sentences, which Ockham calls “terms,” refer to things.

Medieval logicians recognize three types of supposition—material, personal and simple—but their metaphysical commitments affect their analyses. Most everyone agrees about material supposition. It occurs when a term is mentioned rather than used, as is the term “stop” in the sentence, “The sign says ‘stop.’” But they disagree over personal and simple supposition. For Ockham, personal supposition occurs when a term stands for an object in the world, as does the term “cat” in the sentence, “The cat is on the mat” and simple supposition occurs when a term stands for a concept in the mind, as does “horse” in the sentence, “Horse is a species.” For Ockham’s realist opponents, in contrast, the term “species” stands for a universal essence, which is an object in the world. They therefore have a different account of personal and simple supposition.

In addition to three types of supposition, medieval logicians recognize two types of terms: categorematic and syncategorematic. Categorematic terms refer to existing things and are called “categorematic” because, in his Organon, Aristotle asserts that there are ten categories of existing things. Syncategorematic terms do not refer to anything at all. They are logical operators, such as “all,” “not,” “if,” and “only,” which tell how to associate or disassociate the categorematic terms in a sentence.

Among categorematic terms, some are absolute names while others are connotative names. Ockham describes the difference as follows:

Properly speaking, only absolute names, that is, concepts signifying things composed of matter and form, have definitions expressing real essence. Some examples of this sort of name are “human being,” “lion,” and “goat.” Connotative and relative names, on the other hand, which signify one thing directly and another thing indirectly, have definitions expressing nominal essence. Some examples of this sort of name are “white,” “hot,” “parent,” and “child.” [Opera Philosophica IX, p. 554]

The terms “human being” and “parent” are both names for Betty. The term “human being” signifies Betty in an absolute way because it refers to her alone as an independently existing object. The term “parent” signifies Betty in a connotative way because it signifies her while at the same time signifying her children.

c. The Categories

Although the distinction between absolute and connotative terms seems minor, Ockham uses it for radical purposes. According to the standard reading of the Organon, Aristotle holds that there are ten categories of existing things as follows: substance, quality, quantity, relation, place, time, position, state, action, and passion. According to Ockham’s reading, however, Aristotle holds that there are only two categories of existing things: substance and quality. Ockham bases his interpretation on the thesis that only substances and qualities have real essence definitions signifying things composed of matter and form. The other eight categories signify a substance or a quality while connoting something else. They therefore have nominal essence definitions, meaning that they are not existing things.

Consider quantity. Suppose you have one orange. It is a substance with a real essence of citrus fruit. Furthermore, it possesses several qualities, such as its color, its flavor, and its smell. The orange and its qualities are existing things according to Ockham. But the orange is also singular. Is its singularity an existing thing? For mathematical Platonists, the answer is yes: the number one exists as a universal essence and inheres in the orange. Ockham, in contrast, asserts that the singularity of the orange is just a short hand way of saying that there are no other oranges nearby. So, in the sentence “Here is one orange” the term “one” is connotative: it directly signifies the orange itself while indirectly signifying all the other oranges that are not here. Ockham eliminates the rest of the categories along the same lines.

Interestingly, Ockham’s elimination of quantity precipitated his summons to Avignon because it pushed him to a new account of the sacrament of the altar. The sacrament of the altar is the miracle that is supposed to occur when bread and wine are transformed into the body and blood of Jesus Christ. This process is known in theology as “transubstantiation” because one substance changes into another substance. The problem is to explain why the bread and wine continue to look, smell, and taste exactly the same despite the underlying change. According to the standard account, the qualities of the bread and wine continue to inhere in their quantity, which remains the same while substances are exchanged. According to Ockham, however, quantity is nothing other than the substance itself; if the substance changes then the quantity changes. So, the qualities cannot continue to inhere in the same quantity. Nor can they transfer from the substance of the bread and wine into the substance of Jesus because it would be blasphemous to say that Jesus was crunchy or wet! Ockham’s solution is to claim that the qualities of the bread and wine continue to exist all by themselves, accompanying the invisible substance of Jesus down the gullet. Needless to say, this solution was a bit too clever.

One question scholars continue to ask is why Ockham allows for two of the ten categories to remain instead of just one, namely, substance. It seems that qualities, such as whiteness, crunchiness, sweetness, etc, can just as easily be reduced to nominal essences: they signify the substance itself while connoting the tongue or nose or eye that perceives it. Of course, if Ockham had eliminated quality, he really would have had no basis left for saving the miracle of transubstantiation. Perhaps that was reason enough to stay his razor.

6. Theology

a. Fideism

Despite his departures from orthodoxy and his conflict with the papacy, Ockham never renounced Catholicism. He steadfastly embraced fideism, the view that belief in God is a matter of faith alone. Although fideism was soon to become common among Protestant thinkers, it was not so common among medieval Catholics. At the beginning of the Middle Ages, Augustine proposed a proof of the existence of God and promoted the view that reason is faith seeking understanding. While the standard approach for any medieval philosopher would be to recognize a role for both faith and reason in religion, Ockham makes an uncompromising case for faith alone.

Three assertions reveal Ockham to be a fideist.

i. Theology is Not a Science

The word “science” comes from the Latin word “scientia,” meaning knowledge. In the first book of his Sentences, Peter Lombard raises the issue of whether and in what sense theology is a science. Most philosophers commenting on the Sentences found a way to cast faith as a way of knowing. Ockham, however, makes no such effort. As a staunch empiricist, Ockham is committed to the thesis that all knowledge comes from experience. Yet we have no experience of God. It follows inescapably that we have no knowledge of God, as Ockham affirms in the following passage:

In order to demonstrate the statement of faith that we formulate about God, what we would need for the central concept is a simple cognition of the divine nature in itself—what someone who sees God has. Nevertheless, we cannot have this kind of cognition in our present state. [Quodlibetal Questions, pp. 103-4]

By “present state” Ockham is referring to life on earth as a human being. Just as we now have knowledge of others through intuitive cognitions of their individual essences, those who go to heaven (if there ever are any such) will have knowledge of God through intuitive cognitions of his essence. Until then we can only hope.

ii. The Trinity is a Logical Contradiction

The Trinity is the core Christian doctrine according to which God is three persons in one. Christians traditionally consider the Trinity a mystery, meaning that it is beyond the comprehension of the human mind. Ockham goes so far as to admit that it is a blatant contradiction. He displays the problem through the following syllogism:

According to the doctrine of the Trinity:

(1) God is the Father,

and,

(2) Jesus is God.

Therefore, by transitivity, according to the doctrine of the Trinity:

(3) Jesus is the Father.

Yet, according to the doctrine of the Trinity, Jesus is not the Father.

So, according to the doctrine of the Trinity, Jesus both is and is not the Father.

Providing precedent for a recent presidential defense, many medieval philosophers suggested that the transitive inference to the conclusion is broken by different senses of the word “is.” Scotus creatively argues that the logic of the Trinity is an opaque context that does not obey the usual rules. For Ockham, however, this syllogism establishes that theology is not logical and must never be mixed with philosophy.

iii. There Is No Evidence of Purpose in the Natural World

Living prior to the advent of Christianity, Aristotle never believed in the Trinity. He does, however, seem to believe in a supernatural force that lends purpose to all of nature. This is evident in his doctrine of the Four Causes, according to which every existing thing requires a fourfold explanation. Ockham would cast these four causes in terms of the following four questions:

First Cause: What is it made of?
Second Cause: What does it do?
Third Cause: What brought it about?
Fourth Cause: Why does it do what it does?

Most medieval philosophers found Aristotle’s four causes conducive to the Christian worldview, assimilating the fourth cause to the doctrine of divine providence, according to which everything that happens is ultimately part of God’s plan.

Though Ockham was reluctant to disagree with Aristotle, he was so determined to keep theology separate from science and philosophy, that he felt compelled to criticize the fourth (which he calls “final”) cause. Ockham writes,

If I accepted no authority, I would claim that it cannot be proved either from statements known in themselves or from experience that every effect has a final cause…. Someone who is just following natural reason would claim that the question “why?” is inappropriate in the case of natural actions. For he would maintain that it is no real question to ask something like, “For what reason is fire generated?” [Quodlibetal Questions, pp. 246-9]

No doubt Ockham put his criticism in hypothetical, third-person terms because he knew that openly asserting that the universe itself may be entirely purposeless would never pass muster with the powers that be.

b. Against the Proofs of God’s Existence

Needless to say, Ockham rejects all of the alleged proofs of the existence of God. Two of the most important proofs then, as now, were Anselm’s ontological proof and Thomas Aquinas’s cosmological proof. Although the former is based on rationalist thinking and the latter is based on empiricist thinking, they boil down to very similar strategies, in Ockham’s view. There were, of course, many different versions of each of these proofs circulating in Ockham’s day just as there are today. Ockham thinks that the most plausible version of each boils down to an infinite regress argument of the following form:

If God does not exist, then there is an infinite regress.
But infinite regresses are impossible.
Therefore, God must exist.

The reason Ockham finds this argument form to be the most plausible is that he fully agrees with the second premise, that infinite regresses are impossible. If it were possible to show that God’s non-existence implied an infinite regress, then Ockham would accept the inference to his existence. Ockham denies, however, that God’s non-existence implies any such thing.

In order to understand Ockham’s aversion to infinite regress, it is necessary to understand Aristotle’s distinction between extensive and intensive infinity. An extensive infinity is an uncountable quantity of actually existing things. Mathematical Platonists conceive of the set of whole numbers as an extensive infinity. Ockham, however, deems the idea of an uncountable quantity contradictory: if the objects exist, then God can count them, and if God can count them, then they are not uncountable. An intensive infinity, on the other hand, is just a lack of limitation. As a nominalist, Ockham understands the set of whole numbers to be an intensive infinity in the sense that there is no upward limit on how far someone can count. This does not mean that the set of whole numbers are an uncountable quantity of actually existing things. Ockham thinks that infinite regresses are impossible only in so far as they imply extensive infinity.

i. The Ontological Proof

According to Ockham, advocates of the ontological proof reason as follows: There would be an infinite regress among entities if there were not one greatest entity. Therefore, there must be one greatest entity, namely God.

One way to counter this reasoning would be to deny that greatness is an objectively existing quality. Ockham does not, however, take this approach. On the contrary, he seems to take the Great Chain of Being for granted. The Great Chain of Being is a doctrine prevalent throughout the Middle Ages and beyond. According to it, all of nature can be ranked on a hierarchy of value from top to bottom, roughly as follows: God, angels, humans, animals, plants, rocks. The Great Chain of Being implies that greatness is an objectively existing quality.

Ockham’s curt response to the ontological argument is that it does not prove that there is just one greatest entity. Bearing the Great Chain of Being in mind, it is evident what he means to say. If God and the angels do not exist, then human beings are the greatest entities, and there is no single best among us. Notice that, even if there were a single best among humans, he or she would be a “god” in a very different sense than is required by Catholic orthodoxy.

Some scholars have interpreted Ockham to mean that the ontological argument succeeds in proving that the Father, the Son, and the Holy Ghost exist, but not that they are one. It is not clear, however, how Ockham’s empiricism could permit such a conclusion.

ii. The Cosmological Proof

According to Ockham, advocates of the cosmological argument reason as follows: There would be an infinite regress among causes if there were not a first cause; therefore, there must be a first cause, namely, God.

There are two different ways to understand “cause” in this argument: efficient cause and conserving cause. An efficient cause brings about an effect successively over time. For example, your grandparents were the efficient cause of your parents who were the efficient cause of you. A conserving cause, in contrast, is a simultaneous support for an effect. For example, the oxygen in the room is a conserving cause of the burning flame on the candle.

In Ockham’s view, the cosmological argument fails using either type of causality. Consider efficient causality first. If the chain of efficient causes that have produced the world as we know it today had no beginning, then it would form, not an extensive infinity, but an intensive infinity, which is harmless. Since the links in the chain would not all exist at the same time, they would not constitute an uncountable quantity of actually existing things. Rather, they would simply imply that the universe is an eternal cycle of unlimited or perpetual motion. Ockham explicitly affirms that it is possible that the world had no beginning, as Aristotle maintained.

Next, consider conserving causality. Conceiving of the world as a product of simultaneous conserving causes is difficult. The idea is perhaps best expressed in a story reported by Stephen Hawking. According to the story, a scientist was giving a lecture on astronomy. After the lecture, an elderly lady came up and told the scientist that he had it all wrong. “The world is really a flat plate supported on the back of a giant tortoise.” The scientist asked “And what is the turtle standing on?” To which the lady triumphantly replied: “You’re very clever, young man, but it’s no use – it’s turtles all the way down.”

Ockham readily grants that if the world has to be “held up” by conserving causes, then there must be a first among them because otherwise the set of conserving causes would constitute an uncountable quantity of actually existing things. It is in fact a tenet of belief that God is both an efficient and conserving cause of the cosmos, and Ockham accepts this tenet on faith. He handily points out, however, that, just as the cosmos need not have a beginning; it need not be “held up” in this way at all. Each existing thing may be its own conserving cause. Hence the cosmological argument is entirely inconclusive.

Ockham’s fideism amounts to a refusal to rely on the God hypothesis for theory building. It is worth bearing in mind that there were no philosophy departments or philosophy degrees in the Middle Ages. A student’s only choices for graduate school were law, medicine, or theology. Wanting to be a philosopher, Ockham studied theology and ran through his theological exercises, all the while trying to carve out a separate space for philosophy. The one area where the two worlds collide inextricably for him is in ethics.

7. Ethics

a. Divine Command Theory

Many people think God commands human beings to be kind because kindness is good and that God himself is always kind because his actions are always in conformity with goodness.

Although this was and still is the most common way of conceiving of the relationship between God and morality, Ockham disagrees. In his view, God does not conform to an independently existing standard of goodness; rather, God himself is the standard of goodness. This means it is not the case that God commands us to be kind because kindness is good. Rather, kindness is good because God commands it. Ockham was a divine command theorist: God’s will establishes right and wrong.

Divine command theory has always been unpopular because it carries one very unintuitive implication: if whatever God commands becomes right, and God can command whatever he wants, then God could command us always to be unkind and never to be kind, and then it would be right for us to be unkind and wrong for us to be kind. Kindness would be bad and unkindness would be good! How could this be?

In Ockham’s view, God always has commanded and always will command kindness. Nevertheless, it is possible for him to command otherwise. This possibility is a straightforward requirement of divine omnipotence: God can do anything that does not involve a contradiction. Of course, plenty of philosophers, such as Thomas Aquinas, insist that it is impossible for God to command us to be unkind simply because then God’s will would contradict his nature. For Ockham, however, this is the wrong way to conceive of God’s nature. The most important thing to understand about God’s nature, in Ockham’s view, is that it is maximally free. There are no constraints, external or internal, to what God can will. All of theology stands or falls with this thesis in Ockham’s view.

Ockham grants that it is hard to imagine a world in which God reverses his commands. Yet this is the price of preserving divine freedom. He writes,

I reply that hatred, theft, adultery, and the like may involve evil according to the common law, in so far as they are done by someone who is obligated by a divine command to perform the opposite act. As far as everything absolute in these actions is concerned, however, God can perform them without involving any evil. And they can even be performed meritoriously by someone on earth if they should fall under a divine command, just as now the opposite of these, in fact, fall under a divine command. [Opera Theologica V, p. 352]

One advantage of this approach is that it enables Ockham to make sense of some instances in the Old Testament where it looks as though God is commanding such things as murder (as in the case of Abraham sacrificing Isaac) and deception (as in the case of the Israelites despoiling the Egyptians). But biblical exegesis is not Ockham’s motive. His motive is to cast God as a paradigm of metaphysical freedom, so that he can make sense of human nature as made in his image.

b. Metaphysical Libertarianism

Metaphysical libertarianism is the view that human beings are responsible for their actions as individuals because they have free will, defined as the ability to do other than they do. Metaphysical libertarianism is opposed to determinism, according to which human beings do not have free will but rather are determined by antecedent conditions (such as God or nature or environmental factors) to do exactly what they do.

Suppose Jake eats a cupcake. According to the determinist, antecedent conditions caused him to do this. Hence, he could not have done otherwise unless those antecedent conditions had been different. Given the same conditions, Jake cannot refrain from eating the cupcake. Determinists are content to conclude that freedom is an illusion.

Compatibilism is a version of determinism according to which being determined to do exactly what we do is compatible with freedom as long as the antecedent conditions that determine what we do include our own choices. Compatibilists claim that the choices we make are free even though we could not do otherwise given the same antecedent conditions. On this view, Jake chose to eat the cupcake because his desire for it outweighed all other considerations at that moment. Our choices are always determined by our strongest desires according to compatibilists.

Metaphysical libertarians reject determinism and compatibilism, insisting that free will includes the ability to act against our strongest desires. On this view, Jake could have refrained from eating the cupcake even given the exact same antecedent conditions. While desires influence our choices they do not cause our choices according to metaphysical libertarianism; rather, our choices are caused by our will which is itself an uncaused cause, meaning that it is an independent power, stronger than any antecedent condition. This notion of free will enables the metaphysical libertarian to assign a very strong conception of individual responsibility to human beings: what we do is not attributable to God or nature or environmental factors.

Many people make the assumption that all medieval philosophers were metaphysical libertarians. Whereas Protestant theology classically promotes theological determinism, the view that everything human beings do is foreordained by God, Catholic theology classically promotes the view that God gave human beings free will. While it is true that every medieval philosopher endorses the thesis that human beings are free, few are able to maintain a commitment to free will, defined as the ability to do other than we do given the same antecedent conditions. The reason is that so many other theological and philosophical doctrines conflict with it.

Consider divine foreknowledge. If God is omniscient, then he knows everything that you are ever going to do. Suppose he knows that you will eat an apple for lunch tomorrow. How then is it possible for you to choose not to eat an apple for lunch tomorrow? Even if God does not force you in any way, it seems his present knowledge of your future requires that your choices are already determined.

Medieval philosophers struggle with this and other conflicts with free will. Most give up on metaphysical libertarianism in favor of some form of compatibilism. This is to say they maintain that our choices are free even though they are determined by antecedent conditions.

In his Sentences Commentary, Peter John Olivi makes a long and impassioned argument for an unadulterated metaphysical libertarian conception of free will. Ockham embraces Olivi’s position without ever making much of an argument for it. In Ockham’s view, we experience freedom. We can no more dismiss this experience than we can dismiss our experience of the external world. Ockham goes to great lengths to adjust his account of divine foreknowledge and anything else that might otherwise threaten free will in order to accommodate it. He writes,

The will is freely able to will something and not to will it. By this I mean that it is able to destroy the willing that it has and produce anew a contrary effect, or it is equally able in itself to continue that same effect and not produce a new one. It is able to do all of this without any prior change in the intellect, or in the will, or in something outside them. The idea is that the will is equal for producing and not producing because, with no difference in antecedent conditions, it is able to produce and not to produce. It is poised equally over contrary effects in such a way in fact, that it is able to cause love or hatred of something…. To deny every agent this equal or contrary power is to destroy every praise and blame, every council and deliberation, every freedom of the will. Indeed, without it, the will would not make a human being free any more than appetite does an ass. [Opera Philosophica, pp. 319-21]

Ockham’s reference to an ass here is significant in connection with the famous thought experiment known as Buridan’s Ass.

Jean Buridan was a younger contemporary of Ockham’s. Although he embraced and elaborated Ockham’s nominalism, he openly rejected metaphysical libertarianism, arguing that the human intellect determines the human will. He may have engaged in a public debate with Ockham over the nature of human freedom. At any rate, his name somehow became associated with the following thought experiment.

Imagine a hungry donkey poised between two equally delicious piles of hay. The donkey has reason to eat the hay, but because he caught sight of both piles at the same time, he has no more reason to approach one pile than the other. For lack of any way to break the tie, the donkey starves to death. A human being, in contrast, would never make such an ass of himself. The reason is that, in human beings, the will is not determined by the intellect. Free will is the uniquely human dignity that enables us to break the tie between two equally reasonable options.

The French philosopher Pierre Bale (1647-1706) is the first on record to call this thought experiment “Buridan’s Ass.” Although Buridan mentions the case of a dog poised between food and water, he never discusses the case of the donkey in connection with freedom. It is therefore somewhat of a puzzle why the thought experiment is named after him. Interestingly, Peter John Olivi does discuss the case of the donkey in connection with freedom, and we see Ockham echoing that text here.

So, in the end, Ockham’s ethics is dictated by his empiricism. We experience free will. Therefore, free will is at the core of human nature. Theology tells us that we are made in God’s image. Therefore, free will is at the core of God’s nature. But theology also tells us that God is always good. Therefore, God’s free will must be the objective determinant of goodness.

Setting aside his divine command theory, Ockham’s ethics is rather unremarkable, coming to more or less the same thing as that of his colleagues who reject divine command theory. One might think Ockham takes a long way around the barn just to arrive at yet another conventional account of Christian virtue! But Ockham never minds taking the long way around for the sake of consistency. We see the same unflagging determination in his political theory

8. Political Theory

Although Ockham was summoned to the papal court in Avignon to defend a number of “suspect theses” extracted from his work, largely concerning the sacrament of the altar, he was never found guilty of heresy, and his conflict with the papacy ultimately had nothing to do with the sacrament of the altar. While staying in Avignon, Ockham met Michael Cesena (1270-1342), the Minister General of the Franciscan Order, who was there in protest of the Pope’s recent pronouncements about the Franciscan vow of poverty. Michael asked Ockham to study these pronouncements, whereupon Ockham joined the protest and soon became irretrievably entangled in a political imbroglio. Leaving academia behind for good, he nevertheless marshaled his central philosophical insights into the debate. While Ockham was not allowed to publish his political treatises, they circulated widely underground, indirectly influencing major developments in political thought.

a. Rights

Who would have guessed that at the root of these developments lay the Franciscan vow of poverty? In Matthew 19, Jesus says to a man, “If you wish to be perfect, go, sell all you have, give your money to the poor, and come, and follow me.” The man who was to become St. Francis of Assisi (1182-1226) took these instructions personally. Raised in a wealthy family, St. Francis gave up the worldly life, founding the Order of the Friar Minor, and requiring all its members to take a vow of poverty. From the very beginning there was controversy over what exactly this vow entailed. By the 1320s, various factions had come to the breaking point.

Michael Cesena promoted the “radical” interpretation, according to which Franciscans should not only live simply but also own nothing, not even the robes on their backs. Pope Nicholas III (1210/1220-1280) had sanctioned this interpretation by arranging for the papacy officially to possess everything that the Franciscans used, including the very food they ate. Living in absolute poverty enabled the Franciscans to preach convincingly against avarice, and, much to the chagrin of Pope John XXII (1244-1334), raise questions about the ever-expanding papal palace in Avignon.

John was determined to amass great wealth for the church and the Franciscan vow of poverty was getting in the way. Trained as a lawyer, John worked up a good argument for revoking Nicholas’s arrangement. Given that the Franciscans enjoyed exclusive use of the donations they received, they were the de facto owners. Papal “ownership” of Franciscan property was ownership in name alone.

As a nominalist, however, Ockham was in an excellent position to show why reducing something to a name is not the same as reducing it to nothing at all. A name is a mental concept, and a mental concept is an intention. Ockham set out to show that the intention to use is distinct from the intention to own.

Ockham derives his definition of ownership from metaphysical libertarianism. Ownership is not just a conventional relationship established through social agreement. It is a natural relationship that arises through the act of making something of your own free will. Free will naturally confers ownership because it implies sole responsibility. Suppose you freely make a choice. Since you could have done otherwise, you are the true cause of the result. To own something is to do what you will with it.

The Franciscans do not do as they will with the donations given to them, according to Ockham, but rather as the owner wills. They are therefore merely using the donations and do not own them. Granted, in normal practice, this distinction may be entirely undetectable, because the will of the owner matches that of the user. But if a conflict of wills should arise, the distinction would become readily apparent. Suppose someone donates some cloth to the Order intending it to be used for robes. The friars must use it for robes even if they would rather use it for something else. And if the donor wants the cloth back even after it is made into robes, the friars will have no basis for refusing and no legal recourse. Ockham puts the crucial point in terms of crucial language: the owner retains a right (ius) to what he owns.

The notion of a right is one of the most important features of modern political theory. Its emergence in the history of Western thought is a long and complicated story. Nevertheless, the Franciscan poverty debate is standardly considered an important watershed, in which Ockham played a significant role.

b. Separation of Church and State

Ockham extends his commitment to poverty beyond just the Franciscan order, convinced that wealth is an inappropriate source of power for the Catholic Church as a whole. In his view, the Catholic Church has a spiritual power which sets it apart from the secular world. This conviction leads Ockham to propose the doctrine that was to become the foundation of the United States Constitution: separation of church and state.

Throughout the Middle Ages, popes and emperors vied for supremacy across Europe. The political momentum was split in two directions and it was not at all clear which way things would go. One side pushed for hierocracy, where the pope, as the highest authority, appoints the emperor. The other side pushed for imperialism, where the emperor, as the highest authority, appoints the pope. Often the pushing came to shoving; it seemed there would be no end to the ill will and bloodshed.

Ockham boldly proposes a third alternative: the pope and the emperor should be separate but equal, each supreme in his own domain. This was an outrageous suggestion, unwelcome on both sides. Ockham’s argument for it stems from reflections that foreshadow the “state of nature” thought experiments of premier modern political theorists Thomas Hobbes (1588-1679), John Locke (1632-1704) and Jean-Jacques Rousseau (1712-1778).

In the Garden of Eden, God gave the earth to human beings to use to their common benefit. As long as we were willing to share there was no need for property among us. After the fall, however, human beings became selfish and exploitative. Laws became necessary to restrain immoderate appetite for secular or “temporal” goods and to prevent the neglect of their management. Since laws are useless without the ability to enforce them, we arrived at the need for secular power. The function of the secular power is to punish law breakers and in general coerce everyone into obeying the law.

By renouncing property, the Franciscans were attempting to live as God originally intended. In a perfect world, there would be no need for property and the coercive authority it spawns. All Christians should aspire to this anarchic utopia, even though they may never fully achieve it. In the meanwhile, they should avoid mixing the spiritual and the secular as much as possible. Ockham writes,

For this reason, the head of Christians does not, as a rule, have power to punish secular wrongs with a capital penalty and other bodily penalties and it is for thus punishing such wrongs that temporal power and riches are chiefly necessary; such punishment is granted chiefly to the secular power. The pope therefore, can, as a rule, correct wrongdoers only with a spiritual penalty. It is not, therefore, necessary that he should excel in temporal power or abound in temporal riches, but it is enough that Christians should willingly obey him. [A Letter to the Friars Minor and other Writings, p. 204]

For Ockham, the separation of church and state is a separation of the ideal and the real.

Ockham mentions democracy only in passing, arguing in favor of monarchy as the best form of secular government. Moreover, he finds representational forms of government objectionable on the grounds that there is no such thing as a common will. Ockham is not holding out for a superhuman leader. On the contrary, he seems to think that a fairly ordinary, good man can make a decent king. One wonders if Louis of Bavaria, to whose protection he and Michael fled, inspired this confidence. Perhaps Ockham is content with monarchy because, in his view, the secular world will always be intrinsically flawed. He sets his hopes instead on the spiritual world, and this is why he was so bitterly disappointed in Pope John XXII.

c. Freedom of Speech

Ockham’s battle with the papacy continued after John’s death through two successive popes. Although Ockham never came to criticize the institution of the papacy itself, as would later Protestant thinkers, he did accuse the popes he opposed of heresy and called for their expulsion. Ironically, Ockham’s extensive analysis of the concept of heresy turns into a defense of free speech.

In keeping with his doctrine of the separation of church and state, Ockham maintains that the pope, and only the pope, has the right to level spiritual penalties, and only spiritual penalties, against someone who knowingly asserts theological falsehoods and refuses to be corrected. A man might unknowingly assert a theological falsehood a thousand times, however. As long as he is willing to be corrected, he should not be judged a heretic, especially by the pope.

Ockham’s political treatises are strewn with biblical exegesis, often glaringly ad hoc and sometimes quite interesting, as in the present case. In Matthew 28:20 Jesus promises his disciples: “I will be with you always, to the end of the age.” This text traditionally provided justification for the doctrine of papal infallibility according to which the pope cannot be wrong when speaking about official church matters. Ockham rejects this doctrine, however, arguing that the minimum required for Jesus to keep his promise is that one human being remain faithful at any given time, and this one could be anyone, even a single baptized infant. This implies that the entire institution of the church could become completely corrupt. As a result, any theological claim, no matter how ancient or universally accepted, is always open for dispute.

Even more interesting, however, is Ockham’s view of non-theological speech. He writes that

…purely philosophical assertions which do not pertain to theology should not be solemnly condemned or forbidden by anyone, because in connection with such assertions anyone at all ought to be free to say freely what pleases him, [Dialogus, I.2.22]

This statement long predates the Areopagitica of John Milton (1608-1674), which is typically heralded as the earliest defense of free speech in Western history.

Ockham’s contributions in political thought are less known and appreciated than they may have been if he had been able to publish them. Likewise, there is no telling what he might have accomplished in philosophy if he had been allowed to carry on with his academic career. Ockham was ahead of his time. His role in history was to make way for new ideas, boldly planting seeds that grew and flourished after his death.

9. References and Further Reading

a. Ockham’s Works in Latin

William of Ockham, 1967-88. Opera philosophica et theologica. Gedeon Gál, et al., ed. 17 vols. St. Bonaventure, N. Y.: The Franciscan Institute.
William of Ockham, 1956-97. Opera politica. H. S. Offler, et al. ed. 4 vols. Vols. 1-3, Manchester: Manchester University Press, 1956-74. Vol. 4, Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1997.
William of Ockham, 1995-still in progress. Dialogus. John Kilcullen and John Scott, et al. ed. & trans. http://www.britac.ac.uk/pubs/dialogus/ockdial.html

b.Ockham’s Works in English Translation

Adams, Marilyn McCord, and Norman Kretzmann, trans. 1983. William of Ockham: Predestination, God’s Foreknowledge, and Future Contingents. 2nd ed. Indianapolis: Hackett.
Birch, T. Bruce, ed. & trans. 1930. The De sacramento altaris of William of Ockham. Burlington, Iowa: Lutheran Literary Board.
Boehner, Philotheus, ed. & trans. 1990. William of Ockham: Philosophical Writings. Rev. ed. Indianapolis, Ind.: Hackett.
Davies, Julian, trans. 1989. Ockham on Aristotle’s Physics: A Translation of Ockham’s Brevis Summa Libri Physicorum. St. Bonaventure, N. Y.: The Franciscan Institute.
Freddoso, Alfred J., and Francis E. Kelly, trans. 1991. Quodlibetal Questions. New Haven, Conn.: Yale University Press.
Freddoso, Alfred J., and Henry Schuurman, trans. 1980. Ockham’s Theory of Propositions: Part II of the Summa logicae. Notre Dame, Ind.: University of Notre Dame Press.
Kilcullen, John, and John Scott, ed. & trans. 1995-still in progress. Dialogue on the Power of the Emperor and the Pope. http://www.britac.ac.uk/pubs/dialogus/ockdial.html
Kluge, Eike-Henner W., trans. 1973-74. “William of Ockham’s Commentary on Porphyry: Introduction and English Translation.” Franciscan Studies 33, pp. 171-254, and 34, pp. 306-82.
Loux, Michael J. 1974. Ockham’s Theory of Terms: Part I of the Summa Logicae. Notre Dame, Ind.: University of Notre Dame Press.
McGrade, A. S., and John Kilcullen, ed. & trans. 1992. A Short Discourse on the Tyrannical Government over Things Divine and Human. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
McGrade, A. S., and John Kilcullen, ed. & trans. 1995. A Letter to the Friars Minor and Other Writings. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Spade, Paul Vincent, 1994. Five Texts on the Mediaeval Problem of Universals: Porphyry, Boethius, Abelard, Duns Scotus, Ockham. Indianapolis, Ind.: Hackett.
Wood, Rega, trans. 1997. Ockham on the Virtues. West Lafayette, Ind.: Purdue University Press.

c. Books about Ockham

Adams, Marilyn McCord, 1987. William Ockham. 2 vols., Notre Dame, Ind.: University of Notre Dame Press. (2nd rev. ed., 1989.)
Copleston, F.C., 1953. History of Philosophy, Volume III: Ockham to Suarez. London: Search Press.
Goddu, André, 1984. The Physics of William of Ockham. Leiden: E. J. Brill.
Hirvonen, Vesa, 2004. Passions in William Ockham’s Philosophical Psychology. Dordrecht: Kluwer.
Kaye, Sharon M. and Robert Martin, 2001. On Ockham. Belmont: Wadsworth.
Maurer, Armand, 1999. The Philosophy of William of Ockham in the Light of its Principles. Toronto: Pontifical Institute of Medieval Studies.
McGrade, A. S., 1974. The Political Thought of William of Ockham. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Spade, Paul, ed., 1999. The Cambridge Companion to Ockham. New York: Cambridge University Press.
Panaccio, Claude, 2004. Ockham on Concepts. Burlington: Ashgate.
Tauchau, Katherine H., 1988. Vision and Certitude in the Age of Ockham: Optics, Epistemology and the Foundations of Semantics, 1250-1345. Leiden: E. J. Brill.

Author Information

Sharon Kaye
Email: skaye@jcu.edu
John Carroll University
U. S. A.

Pragmatism

Pragmatism is a philosophical movement that includes those who claim that an ideology or proposition is true if it works satisfactorily, that the meaning of a proposition is to be found in the practical consequences of accepting it, and that unpractical ideas are to be rejected. Pragmatism originated in the United States during the latter quarter of the nineteenth century. Although it has significantly influenced non-philosophers—notably in the fields of law, education, politics, sociology, psychology, and literary criticism—this article deals with it only as a movement within philosophy.

The term “pragmatism” was first used in print to designate a philosophical outlook about a century ago when William James (1842-1910) pressed the word into service during an 1898 address entitled “Philosophical Conceptions and Practical Results,” delivered at the University of California (Berkeley). James scrupulously swore, however, that the term had been coined almost three decades earlier by his compatriot and friend C. S. Peirce (1839-1914). (Peirce, eager to distinguish his doctrines from the views promulgated by James, later relabeled his own position “pragmaticism”—a name, he said, “ugly enough to be safe from kidnappers.”) The third major figure in the classical pragmatist pantheon is John Dewey (1859-1952), whose wide-ranging writings had considerable impact on American intellectual life for a half-century. After Dewey, however, pragmatism lost much of its momentum.

There has been a recent resurgence of interest in pragmatism, with several high-profile philosophers exploring and selectively appropriating themes and ideas embedded in the rich tradition of Peirce, James, and Dewey. While the best-known and most controversial of these so-called “neo-pragmatists” is Richard Rorty, the following contemporary philosophers are often considered to be pragmatists: Hilary Putnam, Nicholas Rescher, Jürgen Habermas, Susan Haack, Robert Brandom, and Cornel West.

The article’s first section contains an outline of the history of pragmatism; the second, a selective survey of themes and theses of the pragmatists.

A Pragmatist Who’s Who: An Historical Overview
1. Classical Pragmatism: From Peirce to Dewey
2. Post-Deweyan Pragmatism: From Quine to Rorty
Some Pragmatist Themes and Theses
Conclusion
References and Further Reading

1. A Pragmatist Who’s Who: An Historical Overview

a. Classical Pragmatism: From Peirce to Dewey

In the beginning was “The Metaphysical Club,” a group of a dozen Harvard-educated men who met for informal philosophical discussions during the early 1870s in Cambridge, Massachusetts. Club members included proto-positivist Chauncey Wright (1830-1875), future Supreme Court Justice Oliver Wendell Holmes (1841-1935), and two then-fledgling philosophers who went on to become the first self-conscious pragmatists: Charles Sanders Peirce (1839-1914), a logician, mathematician, and scientist; and William James (1842-1910), a psychologist and moralist armed with a medical degree.

Peirce summarized his own contributions to the Metaphysical Club’s meetings in two articles now regarded as founding documents of pragmatism: “The Fixation of Belief” (1877) and “How To Make Our Ideas Clear” (1878). James followed Peirce with his first philosophical essay, “Remarks on Spencer’s Definition of Mind as Correspondence,” (1878). After the appearance of The Principles of Psychology (1890), James went on to publish The Will to Believe and Other Essays in Popular Philosophy (1896), The Varieties of Religious Experience (1902), Pragmatism: A New Name for Some Old Ways of Thinking (1907), and The Meaning of Truth: A Sequel to Pragmatism (1909). Peirce, unfortunately, never managed to publish a magnum opus in which his nuanced philosophical views were systematically expounded. Still, publish he did, though he left behind a mountain of manuscript fragments, many of which only made it into print decades after his death.

Peirce and James traveled different paths, philosophically as well as professionally. James, less rigorous but more concrete, became an esteemed public figure (and a Harvard professor) thanks to his intellectual range, his broad sympathies, and his Emersonian genius for edifying popularization. He recognized Peirce’s enormous creative gifts and did what he could to advance his friend professionally; but ultimately to no avail. Professional success within academe eluded Peirce; after his scandal-shrouded dismissal from Johns Hopkins University (1879-1884)—his sole academic appointment—he toiled in isolation in rural Pennsylvania. True, Peirce was not entirely cut off: he corresponded with colleagues, reviewed books, and delivered the odd invited lecture. Nevertheless, his philosophical work grew increasingly in-grown, and remained largely unappreciated by his contemporaries. The well-connected James, in contrast, regularly derived inspiration and stimulation from a motley assortment of fellow-travellers, sympathizers, and acute critics. These included members of the Chicago school of pragmatists, led by John Dewey (of whom more anon); Oxford’s acerbic iconoclast F.C.S. Schiller (1864-1937), a self-described Protagorean and “humanist”; Giovanni Papini (1881-1956), leader of a cell of Italian pragmatists; and two of James’s younger Harvard colleagues, the absolute idealist Josiah Royce (1855-1916) and the poetic naturalist George Santayana (1864-1952), both of whom challenged pragmatism while being influenced by it. (It should be noted, however, that Royce was also significantly influenced by Peirce.)

The final member of the classical pragmatist triumvirate is John Dewey (1859-1952), who had been a graduate student at Johns Hopkins during Peirce’s brief tenure there. In an illustrious career spanning seven decades, Dewey did much to make pragmatism (or “instrumentalism,” as he called it) respectable among professional philosophers. Peirce had been persona non grata in the academic world; James, an insider but no pedant, abhorred “the PhD Octopus” and penned eloquent lay sermons; but Dewey was a professor who wrote philosophy as professors were supposed to do—namely, for other professors. His mature works—Reconstruction in Philosophy (1920), Experience and Nature (1925), and The Quest for Certainty (1929)—boldly deconstruct the dualisms and dichotomies which, in one guise or another, had underwritten philosophy since the Greeks. According to Dewey, once philosophers give up these time-honoured distinctions—between appearance and reality, theory and practice, knowledge and action, fact and value—they will see through the ill-posed problems of traditional epistemology and metaphysics. Instead of trying to survey the world sub specie aeternitatis, Deweyan philosophers are content to keep their feet planted on terra firma and address “the problems of men.”

Dewey emerged as a major figure during his decade at the University of Chicago, where fellow pragmatist G.H. Mead (1863-1931) was a colleague and collaborator. After leaving Chicago for Columbia University in 1904, Dewey became even more prolific and influential; as a result, pragmatism became an important feature of the philosophical landscape at home and abroad. Dewey, indeed, had disciples and imitators aplenty; what he lacked was a bona fide successor—someone, that is, who could stand to Dewey as he himself stood to James and Peirce. It is therefore not surprising that by the 1940s—shortly after the publication of Dewey’s Logic: The Theory of Inquiry (1938)—pragmatism had lost much of its momentum and prestige.

This is not to say that pragmatists became an extinct species; C. I. Lewis (1883-1964) and Sidney Hook (1902-1989), for instance, remained prominent and productive. But to many it must have seemed that there was no longer much point in calling oneself a pragmatist—especially with the arrival of that self-consciously rigorous import, analytic philosophy. As American philosophers read more and more of Moore, Russell, Wittgenstein, and the Vienna Circle, many of them found the once-provocative dicta of Dewey and James infuriatingly vague and hazy. The age of grand synoptic philosophizing was drawing rapidly to a close; the age of piecemeal problem-solving and hard-edged argument was getting underway.

b. Post-Deweyan Pragmatism: From Quine to Rorty

And so it was that Deweyans were undone by the very force that had sustained them, namely, the progressive professionalization of philosophy as a specialized academic discipline. Pragmatism, once touted as America’s distinctive gift to Western philosophy, was soon unjustly derided by many rank-and-file analysts as passé. Of the original pragmatist triumvirate, Peirce fared the best by far; indeed, some analytic philosophers were so impressed by his technical contributions to logic and the philosophy of science that they paid him the (dubious) compliment of re-making him in their own image. But the reputations of James and Dewey suffered greatly and the influence of pragmatism as a faction waned. True, W.V.O. Quine´s (1908-2000) landmark article “Two Dogmas of Empiricism” (1951) challenged positivist orthodoxy by drawing on the legacy of pragmatism. However, despite Quine’s qualified enthusiasm for parts of that legacy—an enthusiasm shared in varying degrees by Ludwig Wittgenstein (1889-1951), Rudolf Carnap (1891-1970), Hans Reichenbach (1891-1953), Karl Popper (1902-1994), F.P. Ramsey (1903-1930), Nelson Goodman (1906-1999), Wilfrid Sellars (1912-1989), and Thomas Kuhn (1922-1996)—mainstream analytic philosophers tended to ignore pragmatism until the early 1980s.

What got philosophers talking about pragmatism again was the publication of Richard Rorty’s Philosophy and the Mirror of Nature (1979)—a controversial tome which repudiated the basic presuppositions of modern philosophy with élan, verve, and learning. Declaring epistemology a lost cause, Rorty found inspiration and encouragement in Dewey; for Dewey, Rorty pleaded, had presciently seen that philosophy must become much less Platonist and less Kantian—less concerned, that is, with unearthing necessary and ahistorical normative foundations for our culture’s practices. Once we understand our culture not as a static edifice but as an on-going conversation, the philosopher’s official job description changes from foundation-layer to interpreter. In the absence of an Archimedean point, philosophy can only explore our practices and vocabularies from within; it can neither ground them on something external nor assess them for representational accuracy. Post-epistemological philosophy accordingly becomes the art of understanding; it explores the ways in which those voices which constitute that mutable conversation we call our culture—the voices of science, art, morality, religion, and the like—are related.

In subsequent writings—Consequences of Pragmatism (1982), Contingency, Irony, and Solidarity (1989), Achieving Our Country (1998), Philosophy and Social Hope (1999), and three volumes of Philosophical Papers (1991, 1991, 1998)—Rorty has enthusiastically identified himself as a pragmatist; in addition, he has urged that this epithet can be usefully bestowed on a host of other well-known philosophers—notably Donald Davidson (1917-2003). Though Rorty is the most visible and vocal contemporary champion of pragmatism, many other well-known figures have contributed significantly to the resurgence of this many-sided movement. Prominent revivalists include Karl-Otto Apel (b. 1922), Israel Scheffler (b. 1923), Joseph Margolis (b. 1924), Hilary Putnam (b. 1926), Nicholas Rescher (b. 1928), Jürgen Habermas (b. 1929), Richard Bernstein (b. 1932), Stephen Stich (b. 1944), Susan Haack (b. 1945), Robert Brandom (b. 1950), Cornel West (b. 1953), and Cheryl Misak (b. 1961). There is much disagreement among these writers, however, so it would be grossly misleading to present them as manifesto-signing members of a single sect or clique.

2. Some Pragmatist Themes and Theses

What makes these philosophers pragmatists? There is, alas, no simple answer to this question. For there is no pragmatist creed; that is, no neat list of articles or essential tenets endorsed by all pragmatists and only by pragmatists. Nevertheless, it is possible to identify certain ideas that have loomed large in the pragmatist tradition—though that is not to say that these ideas are the exclusive property of pragmatists, nor that they are endorsed by all pragmatists.

Here, then, are some themes and theses to which many pragmatists have been attached.

a. A Method and A Maxim

Pragmatism may be presented as a way of clarifying (and in some cases dissolving) intractable metaphysical and epistemological disputes. According to the down-to-earth pragmatist, bickering metaphysicians should get in the habit of posing the following question: “What concrete practical difference would it make if my theory were true and its rival(s) false?” Where there is no such difference, there is no genuine (that is, non-verbal) disagreement, and hence no genuine problem.

This method is closely connected to the so-called “pragmatic maxim,” different versions of which were formulated by Peirce and James in their attempts to clarify the meaning of abstract concepts or ideas. This maxim points to a broadly verificationist conception of linguistic meaning according to which no sense can be made of the idea that there are facts which are unknowable in principle (that is, truths which no one could ever be warranted in asserting and which could have absolutely no bearing on our conduct or experience). From this point of view, talk of inaccessible Kantian things-in-themselves—of a “True World” (Nietzsche) forever hidden behind the veil of phenomena—is useless or idle. In a sense, then, the maxim-wielding pragmatist agrees with Oscar Wilde: only shallow people do not judge by appearances.

Moreover, theories and models are to be judged primarily by their fruits and consequences, not by their origins or their relations to antecedent data or facts. The basic idea is presented metaphorically by James and Dewey, for whom scientific theories are instruments or tools for coping with reality. As Dewey emphasized, the utility of a theory is a matter of its problem-solving power; pragmatic coping must not be equated with what delivers emotional consolation or subjective comfort. What is essential is that theories pay their way in the long run—that they can be relied upon time and again to solve pressing problems and to clear up significant difficulties confronting inquirers. To the extent that a theory functions or “works” practically in this way, it makes sense to keep using it—though we must always allow for the possibility that it will eventually have to be replaced by some theory that works even better. (See Section 2b below, for more on fallibilism.) An intriguing variant on this theme can arguably be found in Popper’s falsificationist philosophy of science: though never positively justified, theories (understood as bold conjectures or guesses) may still be rationally accepted provided repeated attempts to falsify them have failed.

b. Anti-Cartesianism

From Peirce and James to Rorty and Davidson, pragmatists have consistently sought to purify empiricism of vestiges of Cartesianism. They have insisted, for instance, that empiricism divest itself of that understanding of the mental which Locke, Berkeley, and Hume inherited from Descartes. According to such Cartesianism, the mind is a self-contained sphere whose contents—“ideas” or “impressions”—are irredeemably subjective and private, and utterly sundered from the public and objective world they purport to represent. Once we accept this picture of the mind as a world unto itself, we must confront a host of knotty problems—about solipsism, skepticism, realism, and idealism—with which empiricists have long struggled. Pragmatists have expressed their opposition to this Cartesian picture in many ways: Peirce´s view that beliefs are rules for action; James’s teleological understanding of the mind; Dewey’s Darwinian-inflected ruminations on experience; Popper’s mockery of the “bucket theory of the mind”; Wittgenstein’s private language argument; Rorty’s refusal to view the mind as Nature’s mirror; and Davidson’s critique of “the myth of the subjective.” In these and other cases, the intention is emancipatory: pragmatists see themselves as freeing philosophy from optional assumptions which have generated insoluble and unreal problems.

Pragmatists also find the Cartesian “quest for certainty” (Dewey) quixotic. Pace Descartes, no statement or judgment about the world is absolutely certain or incorrigible. All beliefs and theories are best treated as working hypotheses which may need to be modified—refined, revised, or rejected—in light of future inquiry and experience. Pragmatists have defended such fallibilism by means of various arguments; here are sketches of five: (1) There is an argument from the history of inquiry: even our best, most impressive theories—Euclidean geometry and Newtonian physics, for instance—have needed significant and unexpected revisions. (2) If scientific theories are dramatically underdetermined by data, then there are alternative theories which fit said data. How then can we be absolutely sure we have chosen the right theory? (3) If we say (with Peirce) that the truth is what would be accepted at the end of inquiry, it seems we cannot be absolutely certain that an opinion of ours is true unless we know with certainty that we have reached the end of inquiry. But how could we ever know that? (See Section 2e below for more on Peirce’s theory of truth.) (4) There is a methodological argument as well: ascriptions of certainty block the road of inquiry, because they may keep us from making progress (that is, finding a better view or theory) should progress still be possible. (5) Finally, there is a political argument. Fallibilism, it is said, is the only sane alternative to a cocksure dogmatism, and to the fanaticism, intolerance, and violence to which such dogmatism can all too easily lead.

Pragmatists have also inveighed against the Cartesian idea that philosophy should begin with bold global doubt—that is, a doubt capable of demolishing all our old beliefs. Peirce, James, Dewey, Quine, Popper, and Rorty, for example, have all emphatically denied that we must wipe the slate clean and find some neutral, necessary or presuppositionless starting-point for inquiry. Inquiry, pragmatists are persuaded, can start only when there is some actual or living doubt; but, they point out, we cannot genuinely doubt everything at once (though they allow, as good fallibilists should, that there is nothing which we may not come to doubt in the course of our inquiries). This anti-Cartesian attitude is summed up by Otto Neurath’s celebrated metaphor of the conceptual scheme as raft: inquirers are mariners who must repair their raft plank by plank, adrift all the while on the open sea; for they can never disembark and scrutinize their craft in dry-dock from an external standpoint. In sum, we must begin in media res—in the middle of things—and confess that our starting-points are contingent and historically conditioned inheritances. One meta-philosophical moral drawn by Dewey (and seconded by Quine) was that we should embrace naturalism: the idea that philosophy is not prior to science, but continuous with it. There is thus no special, distinctive method on which philosophers as a caste can pride themselves; no transcendentalist faculty of pure Reason or Intuition; no Reality (immutable or otherwise) inaccessible to science for philosophy to ken or limn. Moreover, philosophers do not invent or legislate standards from on high; instead, they make explicit the norms and methods implicit in our best current practice.

Finally, it should be noted that pragmatists are unafraid of the Cartesian global skeptic—that is, the kind of skeptic who contends that we cannot know anything about the external world because we can never know that we are not merely dreaming. They have urged that such skepticism is merely a reductio ad absurdum of the futile quest for certainty (Dewey, Rescher); that skepticism rests on an untenable Cartesian philosophy of mind (Rorty, Davidson); that skepticism presupposes a discredited correspondence theory of truth (Rorty); that the belief in an external world is justified insofar as it “works,” or best explains our sensory experience (James, Schiller, Quine); that the problem of the external world is bogus, since it cannot be formulated unless it is already assumed that there is an external world (Dewey); that the thought that there are truths no one could ever know is empty (Peirce); and that massive error about the world is simply inconceivable (Putnam, Davidson).

c. The Kantian Inheritance

Pragmatism’s critique of Cartesianism and empiricism draws heavily—though not uncritically—on Kant. Pragmatists typically think, for instance, that Kant was right to say that the world must be interpreted with the aid of a scheme of basic categories; but, they add, he was dead wrong to suggest that this framework is somehow sacrosanct, immutable, or necessary. Our categories and theories are indeed our creations; they reflect our peculiar constitution and history, and are not simply read off from the world. But frameworks can change and be replaced. And just as there is more than one way to skin a cat, there is more than one sound way to conceptualize the world and its content. Which interpretative framework or vocabulary we should use—that of physics, say, or common sense—will depend on our purposes and interests in a given context.

The upshot of all this is that the world does not impose some unique description on us; rather, it is we who choose how the world is to be described. Though this idea is powerfully present in James, it is also prominent in later pragmatism. It informs Carnap’s distinction between internal and external questions, Rorty’s claim that Nature has no preferred description of itself, Goodman’s talk of world-making and of right but incompatible world-versions, and Putnam’s insistence that objects exist relative to conceptual schemes or frameworks.

Then there is the matter of appealing to raw experience as a source of evidence for our beliefs. According to the tradition of mainstream empiricism from Locke to Ayer, our beliefs about the world ultimately derive their justification from perception. What then justifies one’s belief that the cat is on the mat? Not another belief or judgment, but simply one’s visual experience: one sees said cat cavorting on said mat—and that is that. Since experience is simply “given” to the mind from without, it can justify one’s basic beliefs (that is, beliefs that are justified but whose justification does not derive from any other beliefs). Sellars, Rorty, Davidson, Putnam, and Goodman are perhaps the best-known pragmatist opponents of this foundationalist picture. Drawing inspiration from Kant’s dictum that “intuitions without concepts are blind,” they aver that to perceive is really to interpret and hence to classify. But if observation is theory-laden—if, that is, epistemic access to reality is necessarily mediated by concepts and descriptions—then we cannot verify theories or worldviews by comparing them with some raw, unsullied sensuous “Given.” Hence old-time empiricists were fundamentally mistaken: experience cannot serve as a basic, belief-independent source of justification.

More generally, pragmatists from Peirce to Rorty have been suspicious of foundationalist theories of justification according to which empirical knowledge ultimately rests on an epistemically privileged basis—that is, on a class of foundational beliefs which justify or support all other beliefs but which depend on no other beliefs for their justification. Their objections to such theories are many: that so-called “immediate” (or non-inferential) knowledge is a confused fiction; that knowledge is more like a coherent web than a hierarchically structured building; that there are no certain foundations for knowledge (since fallibilism is true); that foundational beliefs cannot be justified by appealing to perceptual experience (since the “Given” is a myth); and that knowledge has no overall or non-contextual structure whatsoever.

d. Against the Spectator Theory of Knowledge

Pragmatists resemble Kant in yet another respect: they, too, ferociously repudiate the Lockean idea that the mind resembles either a blank slate (on which Nature impresses itself) or a dark chamber (into which the light of experience streams). What these august metaphors seem intended to convey (among other things) is the idea that observation is pure reception, and that the mind is fundamentally passive in perception. From the pragmatist standpoint this is just one more lamentable incarnation of what Dewey dubbed “the spectator theory of knowledge.” According to spectator theorists (who range from Plato to modern empiricists), knowing is akin to seeing or beholding. Here, in other words, the knower is envisioned as a peculiar kind of voyeur: her aim is to reflect or duplicate the world without altering it—to survey or contemplate things from a practically disengaged and disinterested standpoint.

Not so, says Dewey. For Dewey, Peirce, and like-minded pragmatists, knowledge (or warranted assertion) is the product of inquiry, a problem-solving process by means of which we move from doubt to belief. Inquiry, however, cannot proceed effectively unless we experiment—that is, manipulate or change reality in certain ways. Since knowledge thus grows through our attempts to push the world around (and see what happens as a result), it follows that knowers as such must be agents; as a result, the ancient dualism between theory and practice must go by the board. This insight is central to the “experimental theory of knowledge,” which is Dewey’s alternative to the discredited spectatorial conception.

This repudiation of the passivity of observation is a major theme in pragmatist epistemology. According to James and Dewey, for instance, to observe is to select—to be on the lookout for something, be it for a needle in a haystack or a friendly face in a crowd. Hence our perceptions and observations do not reflect Nature with passive impartiality; first, because observers are bound to discriminate, guided by interest, expectation, and theory; second, because we cannot observe unless we act. But if experience is inconceivable apart from human interests and agency, then perceivers are truly explorers of the world—not mirrors superfluously reproducing it. And if acceptance of some theory or other always precedes and directs observation, we must break with the classical empiricist assumption that theories are derived from independently discovered data or facts.

Again, it is proverbial that facts are stubborn things. If we want to find out how things really are, we are counseled by somber common-sense to open our eyes (literally as well as figuratively) and take a gander at the world; facts accessible to observation will then impress themselves on us, forcing their way into our minds whether we are prepared to extend them a hearty welcome or not. Facts, so understood, are the antidote to prejudice and the cure for bias; their epistemic authority is so powerful that it cannot be overridden or resisted. This idea is a potent and reassuring one, but it is apt to mislead. According to holists such as James and Schiller, the justificatory status of beliefs is partly a function of how well they cohere or fit with entrenched beliefs or theory. Since the range of “facts” we can countenance or acknowledge is accordingly constrained by our body of previous acquired beliefs, no “fact” can be admitted into our minds unless it can be coherently assimilated or harmonized with beliefs we already hold. This amounts to a rejection of Locke’s suggestion that the mind is a blank slate, that is, a purely receptive and patient tabula rasa.

e. Beyond The Correspondence Theory of Truth

According to a longstanding tradition running from Plato to the present-day, truth is a matter of correspondence or agreement with reality (or with the aforementioned “facts”). But this venerable view is vague and beset with problems, say pragmatists. Here are just four: (1) How is this mysterious relation called “correspondence” to be understood or explicated? Not as copying, surely; but then how? (2) The correspondence theory makes a mystery of our practices of verification and inquiry. For we cannot know whether our beliefs are correspondence-true: if the “Given” is a myth, we cannot justify theories by comparing them with an unconceptualized reality. (3) It has seemed to some that traditional correspondence theories are committed to the outmoded Cartesian picture of the mind as Nature’s mirror, in which subjective inner representations of an objective outer order are formed. (4) It has also been urged that there is no extra-linguistic reality for us to represent—no mind-independent world to which our beliefs are answerable. What sense, then, can be made of the suggestion that true thoughts correspond to thought-independent things?

Some pragmatists have concluded that the correspondence theory is positively mistaken and must be abandoned. Others, more cautious, merely insist that standard formulations of the theory are uninformative or incomplete. Schiller, Rorty, and Putnam all arguably belong to the former group; Peirce, James, Dewey, Rescher, and Davidson, to the latter.

Apart from criticizing the correspondence theory, what have pragmatists had to say about truth? Here three views must be mentioned: (1) James and Dewey are often said to have held the view that the truth is what “works”: true hypotheses are useful, and vice versa. This view is easy to caricature and traduce—until the reader attends carefully to the subtle pragmatist construal of utility. (What James and Dewey had in mind here was discussed above in Section 2a.) (2) According to Peirce, true opinions are those which inquirers will accept at the end of inquiry (that is, views on which we could not improve, no matter how far inquiry on that subject is pressed or pushed). Peirce’s basic approach has inspired later pragmatists such as Putnam (whose “internal realism” glosses truth as ideal rational acceptability) as well as Apel and Habermas (who have equated truth with what would be accepted by all in an ideal speech situation). (3) According to Rorty, truth has no nature or essence; hence the less said about it, the better. To call a belief or theory “true” is not to ascribe any property to it; it is merely to perform some speech act (for example, to recommend, to caution, etc.). As Rorty sees it, his fellow pragmatists—James, Dewey, Peirce, Putnam, Habermas, and Apel—all err in thinking that truth can be elucidated or explicated.

3. Conclusion

For the most part, pragmatists have thought of themselves as reforming the tradition of empiricism—though some have gone further and recommended that tradition’s abolition. As this difference of opinion suggests, pragmatists do not vote en bloc. There is no such thing as the pragmatist party-line: not only have pragmatists taken different views on major issues (for example, truth, realism, skepticism, perception, justification, fallibilism, realism, conceptual schemes, the function of philosophy, etc.), they have also disagreed about what the major issues are. While such diversity may seem commendably in keeping with pragmatism’s professed commitment to pluralism, detractors have urged it only goes to show that pragmatism stands for little or nothing in particular. This gives rise to a question as awkward as it is unavoidable—namely, how useful is the term “pragmatism”? That question is wide open.

4. References and Further Reading

Borradori, G. (Ed.) The American Philosopher. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1994.
Flower, E. and Murphey, M. A History of Philosophy in America. New York: Putnam, 1997.
Kuklick, B. A History of Philosophy in America: 1720-2000. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2002.
McDermid, D. The Varieties of Pragmatism: Truth, Realism, and Knowledge from James to Rorty. London and New York: Continuum, 2006.
Menand, L. The Metaphysical Club: A Story of Ideas in America. New York: Farrar Straus Giroux, 2001.
Murphy, J. Pragmatism: From Peirce to Davidson. Boulder: Westview Press, 1990.
Scheffler, I. Four Pragmatists: A Critical Introduction to Peirce, James, Mead, and Dewey. London and New York: Routledge & Kegan Paul, 1986.
Shook, J. and Margolis, J. (Eds.) A Companion to Pragmatism. Oxford: Blackwell, 2006.
Stuhr, J. (Ed.) Pragmatism and Classical American Philosophy: Essential Readings and Interpretive Essays. New York: Oxford University Press, 1999.
Thayer, H.S. Meaning and Action: A Critical History of Pragmatism. 2nd ed. Indianapolis: Hackett, 1981.
West, C. The American Evasion of Philosophy: A Genealogy of Pragmatism. Madison: University of Wisconsin Press, 1989.

Author Information

Douglas McDermid
Email: dmcdermi@trentu.ca
Trent University
Canada

Richard Rorty (1931—2007)

Richard Rorty was an important American philosopher of the late twentieth and early twenty-first century who blended expertise in philosophy and comparative literature into a perspective called “The New Pragmatism” or “neopragmatism.” Rejecting the Platonist tradition at an early age, Rorty was initially attracted to analytic philosophy. As his views matured he came to believe that this tradition suffered in its own way from representationalism, the fatal flaw he associated with Platonism. Influenced by the writings of Darwin, Gadamer, Hegel and Heidegger, he turned towards Pragmatism.

Rorty’s thinking as a historicist and anti-essentialist found its fullest expression in 1979 in his most noted book, Philosophy and the Mirror of Nature. Abandoning all claims to a privileged mental power that allows direct access to things-in-themselves, he offered an alternative narrative which adapts Darwinian evolutionary principles to the philosophy of language. The result was an attempt to establish a thoroughly naturalistic approach to issues of science and objectivity, to the mind-body problem, and to concerns about the nature of truth and meaning. In Rorty’s view, language is to be employed as an adaptive tool used to cope with the natural and social environments to achieve a desired, pragmatic end.

Motivating his entire program is Rorty’s challenge to the notion of a mind-independent, language-independent reality that scientists, philosophers, and theologians appeal to when professing their understanding of the truth. This greatly influences his political views. Borrowing from Dewey’s writings on democracy, especially where he promotes philosophy as the art of the politically useful leading to policies that are best, Rorty ties theoretical inventiveness to pragmatic hope. In place of traditional concerns about whether what one believes is well-grounded, Rorty, in Philosophy and Social Hope (1999), advises that it is better to focus on whether one has been imaginative enough to develop interesting alternatives to one’s present beliefs. His assumption is that in a foundationless world, creative, secular humanism must replace the quest for an external authority (God, Nature, Method, and so forth) to provide hope for a better future. He characterizes that future as being free from dogmatically authoritarian assertions about truth and goodness. Thus, Rorty sees his New Pragmatism as the legitimate next step in completing the Enlightenment project of demystifying human life, by ridding humanity of the constricting “ontotheological” metaphors of past traditions, and thereby replacing the power relations of control and subjugation inherent in these metaphors with descriptions of relations based on tolerance and freedom.

Life
Thoughts and Work
Major Influences
Positions
Critics
References and Further Reading

1. Life

Richard McKay Rorty was born on October 4, 1931 in New York City. He held teaching positions at Yale University from 1954 to 1956, Wellesley College from 1958 to 1961, Princeton University from 1961 to 1982, and the University of Virginia since 1982. In addition he has held many visiting positions.

As he relates in his autobiographical piece, “Trotsky and the Wild Orchids,” Rorty’s early and informal education began with the books in his parents’ library, particularly Leon Trotsky’s two books History of the Russian Revolution and Literature and Revolution as well as two volumes on the Dewey Commission of Inquiry into the Moscow Trials. These materials, along with his family’s association with noted socialists such as John Frank and Carlo Tresca, introduced Rorty to the plight of oppressed peoples and the fight for social justice.

At the age of fifteen in 1946, Rorty entered the University of Chicago where he eventually earned B.A. and M.A. degrees. After initially embracing Platonism and its replacement of passion by reason as a method to harmonize reality with the ideals of justice, a reluctant Rorty came to hold that this rapprochement was impossible. Opting rather for the rigors of the study of the philosophy of mind and analytic philosophy, Rorty left Chicago for Yale University, where he received his Ph.D. degree in 1956. He developed the theory of eliminativism materialism in “Mind-body Identity, Privacy and Categories” (1965), The Linguistic Turn (1967) and “In Defense of Eliminative Materialism” (1970). Here he clarifies and adjusts his commitment to the analytic tradition, a commitment that began with his Ph.D. dissertation “The Concept of Potentiality.” He eventually was to become disenchanted with analytic philosophy.

After reading Hegel’s Phenomenology of the Spirit, Rorty began to appreciate the degree to which the incessant conflict of philosophers and their competing first principles might, with the cunning of reason, be transformed from a seemingly interminable debate into a conversation that weaves itself into a “conceptual fabric of a freer, better, more just society.” This appreciation matured with Rorty’s study of Heidegger’s works.

During his tenure at Princeton University, Rorty was reintroduced to the works of John Dewey that he had set aside for his studies on Plato. It was this reacquaintance with Dewey, along with an acquaintance with the writings of Wilfrid Sellars and W. V. Quine that caused Rorty to redirect his interest to the study and development of the American philosophy of Pragmatism.

The publication of his first book, Philosophy and the Mirror of Nature in 1979, the same year he became President of the American Philosophical Association, publicly marked Rorty’s thorough break with Platonic essentialism as well as with Cartesian foundationalism. He attacked assumptions at the core of modern epistemology—the conceptions of mind, of knowledge and of the discipline of philosophy.

Calling himself “raucously secularist,” Rorty rejected contemporary attempts at holding justice and reality in a single vision, declaring this to be a remnant of what Heidegger called the ontotheological tradition whose metaphors had frozen into dogmatic truisms about truth and goodness. In Contingency, Irony and Solidarity (1989), Rorty extended this claim by abandoning all pretenses to an analytic style. Opting for a Proust-inspired narrative approach where arguments for universal rights, common humanity, and justice are replaced with references to pain and humiliation as motivation for society to form solidarities (contingent groupings of like-minded individuals) in opposition to suffering, Rorty substituted hope for knowledge as the main thrust of his efforts. Tolerant conversations rather than philosophical debates and idiosyncratic re-creation rather than self-discovery have been hallmarks of his pragmatic pursuit for social hope, the pursuit of which can be characterized as a historicist quest for human happiness that abandons a search for universal truth and timeless goodness in favor of what works. Rorty’s pragmatic aim was and continues to be the development of a liberal society where there is freedom from pain and humiliation and where open-mindedness is practiced.

More recently, Rorty developed his notion of the uses of philosophy by using as his template a reading of Darwinian evolution applied to Deweyan democratic principles. This development appears most notably in Achieving Our Country (1998), Truth and Progress: Philosophical Papers III (1998) and in Philosophy and Social Hope (1999). Rorty died on June 8, 2007.

2. Thoughts and Work

The failure of Rorty’s youthful attempt to synthesize into one vision his identification with the downtrodden together with his search for the “Truth beyond hypothesis” was the making of his career in philosophy. As early as 1967, Rorty had moved away from an initial interest in linguistic philosophy as a way of finding a neutral standpoint from which to establish a strict science of language, and he began his shift to pragmatism. With the publication of Philosophy and the Mirror of Nature (1979), Rorty further elucidated his maturing anti-essentialist, historicist positions as applied to topics such as the philosophy of science and the mind-body problem, as well as the philosophy of language as it pertained to issues of truth and meaning. With Consequences of Pragmatism (1982), Rorty developed in greater detail the themes covered in his 1979 work.

With Contingency, Irony and Solidarity (1989), Rorty first implicitly linked his rejection of philosophical appeals to ahistorical universals with that of his pragmatist narrative, a narrative of free, idiosyncratic individuals who, inspired by intuitions and sensibilities captured in great works of literature, commit themselves to contingent solidarities devoted to social and political liberalism. Furthermore, these individuals, detached from the need to justify their world-view by an appeal to the way the world is, would see moral obligation as a matter of social conditioning by cultural forces, which are in turn structured by the prevalent human needs and desires of a specific era.

In Part III of Objectivity, Relativism and Truth (1991), Rorty continued to develop his pragmatist views on politics in a democratic society. In Parts I and II he set his sights on contemporary ideas about objectivity, using the writings of Donald Davidson and others for support in debunking the claim that the human mind is capable of discovering ahistorical truth concerning the nature and meaning of reality from a “God’s-eye,” ideal perspective. Supporting the entire work is Rorty’s challenge to the notion of a mind-independent, language-independent reality to which scientists, philosophers, and politicians appeal when professing that they have a corner on the truth. His Essays on Heidegger and Others (1991) is devoted to harmonizing the works of Heidegger and Derrida with the writings of Dewey and Davidson, particularly in their anti-representational insights and stances on contingent historicism.

Later writings, such as Truth and Progress (1998); Achieving our Country: Leftist Thoughts in Twentieth-Century America (1998); and Philosophy and Social Hope (1999), clarify his anti-essentialist stance by integrating a neo-Darwinian perspective into a Dewey-inspired pragmatism.

3. Major Influences

Although the writing of any philosopher will have countless influences, there are generally only a handful which stand out as major inspirations. Rorty is no exception. While Nietzsche, Wittgenstein, Derrida, James, Quine, and Kuhn contribute much to his worldview, of central importance to Rorty’s narrative of New Pragmatism are five influential thinkers: G. W. F. Hegel, Charles Darwin, Martin Heidegger, John Dewey, and Donald Davidson, each contributing a significant layer to Rorty’s complex take on questions central to contemporary philosophy.

a. Hegel’s Historicism as Protopragmatism

It was G. W. F. Hegel’s willingness in his Phenomenology of the Spirit (1977) to abandon certainty and eternity as philosophical and moral goals/ideals that inspired Rorty to appreciate the irreducible temporality of everything as well as to understand philosophy as a contingent narrative readable without a moral precept existing behind the storyline. Calling Hegel’s switch from the metaphor of individual salvation through contact with a transcendental reality to salvation through the achievement of the completion of an historical process “protopragmatism,” Rorty asserts that this move was a critical step forward in human thinking, taking us from the notion of how things were meant to be to a perspective on how things never were but might be. The change of focus from epistemological stasis, the adequate discernment of God’s Will or Nature’s Way, to interpretive processes opened the way for subsequent intellectuals to envision their task as that of constructing a better future rather than the discovery and conforming to a static idea of the Good Life. The refocused purpose of philosophy, from Rorty’s perspective, would be best captured by Hegel’s phrase “time held in thought,” that is, a narrative of a community’s progress across time that can be described in terms of its current and parochial needs; societal growth not measured against some non-human, eternal standard. Thus, Rorty contends, Hegel helped us to begin to substitute pragmatic hope for apodictic knowledge.

Of course, Hegel saw his own philosophical efforts as elucidating the progression by which the rational becomes real. That is, he conceived history as the process of the Absolute becoming increasingly self-manifest (the Incarnate Logos) through the development toward, and concrete realization in, the human consciousness. This Rorty rejects as a form of pantheistic fantasy that attempts to maintain a “closeness of fit” between word and world by rendering humanity as the mere manifestation of the Divine Mind, and one that is not consistent, ironically, with Hegel’s own anti-representational doctrine of historicism. To address this inconsistency and for a corrective to Hegel’s Absolute Idealism, Rorty turns to Charles Darwin.

b. Darwin’s Evolution

In 1998 Rorty contended that Darwin has demonstrated how to naturalize Hegel by the former’s dispensing with claims that the real is rational while allowing for a narrative of change understood as an endless series of progressive unfolding. Purpose that transcends a given organism is eliminated in favor of a particular organism’s fitness for the local environment. It is an evolutionary process, one that fully involves human beings; we are no exception. What we, as creatures of the earth, do and are, Rorty maintains, “is continuous with what amoebas, spiders, and squirrels do and are.” Consciousness and thought are not distinct kinds; they are inextricably linked to the use of language. Language is the practice of using long and complex strings of noises and marks to successfully adapt to one’s environment. If language is at all a break in the continuity between other species and humans, it is only insofar as it is a tool that humans have at their disposal, which amoebas, squirrels, and the like do not. Nevertheless, just as other species have developed the tools of night-hunting, migration and hibernation to adapt to environmental change, we have used language as a tool for our survival. Thus, for Rorty, language is not a mysterious add-on over and above human creaturehood, but part of our “animality,” as he puts it. As a conveyer of meaning, language should be understood as the use of sentences to achieve a practical goal through a cooperative effort. It is “the ability to have and ascribe sentential attitudes” that contributes to our species’ successful survival in a world of dynamic possibilities. In this way, borrowing from Darwin, Rorty naturalizes language.

Darwin also has made materialism respectable to an educated public once, according to Rorty (Truth and Progress, 1998), his “vitalism” is dismissed. Darwin’s detailed account of the way in which both life and consciousness might have evolved from non-living, non-conscious chemical soup gave plausibility to their emergence free from teleology. Taking the new-found respectability of materialism along with the recognition of the human species’ full-fledged animality, the search for a non-natural cause for the prolific display of life on earth can be dispensed with as misguided. So too can a hunt for a non-human purpose for human life. “After Darwin,” Rorty asserts, “it became possible to believe that nature is not leading up to anything—that nature has nothing in mind.”

Without transcendent standards or intrinsic ends to aspire to, we humans find ourselves radically free to invent the purpose of human life and the means to achieve it. Rorty, well aware of the need for a consistent anti-representationalist narrative, acknowledges that even Darwin’s theory of evolutionary change is just one more image of the way things “are,” one no more privileged than any other coherent narrative in representing reality in-itself—an impossible task. In fact Rorty suggests that the main, albeit unintended, contribution of Darwin is the de-mythologizing of the human self (considered as part of an unnarrated, objective reality). Rorty argues that we should “read Darwin not as offering one more theory about what we really are but as providing reasons why we do not need to ask what we really are.” Old habits of deferentially attributing to an immaterial spirit or to nature’s intrinsic life-force (for example, élan vital) the power to determine the structure, meaning of, and means to our existence ought to be set aside as outmoded and replaced by a story of dynamic cultural innovation and humanistic pluralism. This is the pragmatic vocabulary that Rorty envisions Darwin preparing with his notion of evolutionary change, a vocabulary that is further molded by the writings of Martin Heidegger.

c. Heidegger: Contingency over Certainty

Martin Heidegger influenced Rorty in the direction of process over permanence. Labeling the history of Western metaphysics “the ontotheological tradition,” Heidegger postulated that an underlying assumption persisted from Plato down to the positivists: the power relation of “the stronger overcoming the weaker.” Rorty (in “Heidegger, Contingency, and Pragmatism,” 1991) notes that Heidegger finds that thinkers as diverse as Aristotle, St. Paul, Descartes, and Hegel assume this sort of asymmetrical power relation in the process of searching for the truth that overcomes ignorance, tames sensual desire by reason, or defeats sin with the aid of God’s grace. Each thinker in his own fashion seeks a force that overwhelms the subject as it makes its project evident. By doing so, the individual ceases to create and live his own projects in deference to the presence of the stronger influence. The submission to this influence would be both a concession to a power greater than oneself and identification with it. And it is in this identification, Heidegger claimed, that a subtle shift from an attitude of subservience to one of control and domination occurs within the seeker.

Rorty agrees with Heidegger that the “quest for certainty, clarity, and direction from outside can also be viewed as an attempt to escape from time, to view Sein as something that has little to do with Zeit.” For the ontotheological tradition, time, in its fleeting manifestations, receives the unfavorable comparison with the reality of the eternal. Thus the unspoken goal of the metaphysically-inclined advocates of this philosophical tradition is to be free from the contingency, the uncertainty, and the fragility of the human condition by a release into and identification with the eternal. Valuing power above fragility, propositions over words, truth to metaphor, philosophy above poetry, in the hands of pre-Heideggerian philosophers the use of language becomes merely a means in the pursuit of a reality and a force which rises above the signifier.

Heidegger rejected this family of philosophical thinking along with its “quest for disinterested theoretical truth” as an over-intellectualized escape from the human condition. It is at its core inauthentic. The will to truth of the metaphysician is actually the poetic urge in disguise. Since antiquity, the ontotheological tradition is the attempt by (poetic) thinkers to deploy a series of metaphors to break away from the contingency of poetic metaphor. More than hypocritical, in Heidegger eyes, the ontotheologian exhibits hubris in his belief that Western philosophy is capable of getting it right and be clear about what is real, rather than appreciating his attempt as just one of many practices trying to give voice to the “reality” of Being. Instead Heidegger urged that an amalgamation of beliefs and desires had to be made in order to recover and reassert the “force of words” heard as when they were first spoken—original and potent—in order to open a space for Being.

Rorty understands Heidegger to be saying that there are just we humans and the power of the words we happen to speak. There is no designer, no controller, and no choreographer of human projects, only ourselves and the languages we create. “We are nothing save the words we use.” Thus the poet, in dealing forthrightly with the contingency and historicity of words is an authentic coiner of metaphor. And metaphor is what discloses Being, just as Being is formed and manifested in metaphor. As Rorty writes in “Heidegger, Contingency, and Pragmatism,” “As long as an understanding of Being is ontically possible ‘is there’ Being.”

The use of the term “Being” by Heidegger is, for Rorty, somewhat problematic. With Heidegger, Rorty agrees that there is no hidden power called Being. Rorty interprets Heidegger’s Being as what “final vocabularies” are about. When he declares that “Being’s poem is the poem of Being,” Rorty is not claiming that there is a work of reality that Being “writes”; rather he means that there is no meta-vocabulary to distinguish the adequacy of one final vocabulary above others. Nor is there any non-linguistic, pre-cognitive access to an already present Being that underscores some narrative as preferred. There is no way to escape the contingencies of language to get at Being-in-itself. We are all enmeshed in final vocabularies that present Being in diverse and incommensurate ways. No understanding of Being is better than any other understanding. Heidegger thus cleared the way for Rorty’s dismissal of the realism-antirealism debate and his gloss of Western tradition as the development of pragmatic practices designed to cope with contemporary conditions while remaining open to future descriptions.

Nevertheless, for Heidegger the evolving pattern of power relations that has been the history of Western metaphysics culminates in the “technical,” pragmatic interpretation of thinking. Rorty obviously must differ with Heidegger in the latter’s rejection of pragmatism as the concluding, and unfortunate, outcome of the ontotheological tradition. In “Heidegger, Contingency, and Pragmatism,” Rorty suggests that if Heidegger had only to choose between pragmatism and Platonism, pragmatism would be his choice, fully aware of Heidegger’s distain for pragmatism and his offering of a third option: authentic Dasein’s primal understanding of Being. Yet Rorty maintains that he opts for the early Heidegger’s construal of the “analytic of Dasein” as an interpretation of the Western world-view rather than the later Heidegger’s reading of it as “an account of the ahistorical conditions for the occurrence of history.” In doing so Rorty dismisses all suggestions by Heidegger that some historically embedded language-users’ understanding of Being (for example, the ancient Greeks’) can be more open to (less forgetful of) Being than any subsequent appreciation due to their status as “primordial” inventors of the Western tradition’s metaphors. Yet Rorty also insists that it is impossible to rank understandings because no descriptive account can better help us get behind that which is poetically construed. There is no validating reality behind our narrative; Being and interpretive narrative arise together. Therefore, Rorty appropriates for pragmatism only Heidegger’s sense of contingency and the transitory condition of human life, along with the ability to radically redescribe Western culture. He sets aside Heidegger’s nostalgia for an authentic world-view that says something neutral about the structure of all present and possible world-views. By doing so, Rorty aligns himself more with John Dewey’s brand of anti-essentialism and anti-foundationalism than with Heidegger’s project. For Dewey’s vision of a democratic utopia includes “technical,” pragmatic thinking that is put in service to social practice for the purpose of achieving the integration of inquiry and poetry, theory and practice.

d. Dewey’s Pragmatic Democracy

As with Hegel and Darwin, Rorty intentionally “misreads” or “redescribes” John Dewey from a late-Twentieth-century pragmatist’s perspective. This “hypothetical Dewey” is shorn of what Rorty considers to be dead metaphors in the former’s philosophy (that is his “scientistic” empirical rhetoric and panpsychic notion of experience). Conversely for Rorty, a continuing live option in Dewey’s thought is his naturalism and pragmatism. Seen in this light, Rorty’s Dewey becomes the synthesis of historicism and the expediency of evolutionary adaptation. Most notably, Dewey manifested this fusion in his rejection of the “crust of convention” born of a tradition that took language as representational of reality rather than as instrumental in satisfying a society’s shared beliefs and hopes. The fading conviction originating with Plato that language can adequately represent what there is in words opens the way for a pragmatic utilization of language as a means to address current needs through practical deliberations among thoughtful people.

This view of language is critical for Rorty. With the shift in attitude away from the expectation, on one hand, that through narrative a revelation of moral perfection may become manifest, or, on the other, that through the clear and methodical use of language epistemic certainty may be achieved, humanity is freed to view morality and science as being evolving processes, where means lead to ends and those ends in turn become means toward future aims. Rorty characterizes this, Dewey’s means-ends continuum, as the claim that we change our ideas of what is true, right and good on the basis of the particular blend of success and failure produced by our prior labors to fulfill our hopes. Rorty writes that philosophers such as Dewey “have kept alive the historicist sense that this century’s ‘superstition’ was the last century’s triumph of reason and the relativist sense that the latest vocabulary, borrowed from the latest scientific achievement, may not express privileged representations of essences, but be just another of the potential infinity of vocabularies in which the world can be described.”

In rejecting representationalism and the essentialism that it implies, Dewey abandons the Cartesian-inspired spectator account of knowledge, which radically separates the knowing subject from the object being studied. No longer considering that objectivity a result of a detachment from the material under study but rather as an ongoing interaction with that which is at hand, Dewey elevates practice over theory; better said, he puts theory in service to practice. From Rorty’s perspective, while Dewey had a great insight, he ought to have taken the next step and rejected scientism—the claim that scientific method allows humanity to gain a privileged insight into the structural processes of nature. His failure to reject the alleged epistemologically privileged stance is one main reason Rorty must re-imagine Dewey. Nevertheless, Dewey’s elevation of practice continues the movement away from the pre-Darwinian attachment to the belief in a non-human source of purpose and the immutability of natural kinds toward a contingent “world,” where humans define and redefine their social and material environments. It is within a social practice or a “language-game” that specific marks and sounds come to designate commonly accepted meanings. And, as Rorty states in “Feminism and Pragmatism,” (1995) no set of marks or sounds (memes) can ever bring cognitive clarity about the way the world is or the way we as humans are. Instead, memes compete with one another in an evolutionary struggle over cultural space, just as genes compete for survival in the natural environment. Unguided by an immanent or transcendent teleology, the memes’ replication is determined by their usefulness within a given social group. And it is through their utility for the continued existence and prospering of a social group that the group’s memes—like their genes—are carried forward and flourish. They establish their niche in the socio-ecological system.

By the linkage of meme selection with Darwinian natural selection, Rorty can reasonably say that “the history of social practices is continuous with the history of biological evolution.” He adds a crucial caveat: memes gradually usurp the role of genes. Thus the driving force in human existence becomes the socio-linguistic. And as in the process of natural selection there is no social practice that is privileged and final; no one cultural “species” is intrinsically favored over another. It follows that, as Dewey has said “The worse or evil is a rejected good.” Before deliberation and choice there can be no intrinsic good, no God’s-Eye clarity as to what the true, the right and the just are. All options are competing goods. It is only with the triumph of one set of memes over another by means of manipulation, coercion or force that the determination of a society’s memes as the good (or the bad) of the situation can be asserted. Rorty recognizes that the Deweyan approach, which denies that knowledge is the stable grasping of an independent reality and which asserts “reality” to be a term of value, may lead to the charge of relativism and power-worship. But he believes that the benefits for a democratic society where there is an unfettered competition of ideas outweigh the downside of his anti-universalist stance. Therefore, given the historicist belief that there is no viable alternative to being immersed within the contemporary understanding of one’s time, place and culture, then to abandon the memes with which one chooses to be identified—together with the solidarity one has formed with like-minded others around those memes—would be an absurd denial of one’s self and one’s beliefs. (This is the basis of Rorty’s ethnocentricism.)

Rorty wishes to promote consciously a democracy of plurality and hope rather than one where either private autonomy or communal solidarity dominates. This sentiment can be found most clearly beginning with Contingency, Irony and Solidarity (1989), culminating in Philosophy and Social Hope (1999). By developing an evolutionary sense of history through Dewey’s writings Rorty associates a generalized Darwinism directly with democracy. Growth, or the flourishing of ideas in a political environment that is conducive to the flowering of ideas and practices, is the hope for the future. While there is no metaphysical grounding of this hope in the essence of humanity or in the structure of the world, Rorty maintains that a future where we may continue to be astounded by the latest creative endeavors is a future where human happiness has the best chance.

This democratic trope is acceptable to Rorty because he agrees with Dewey that the essentialist-foundationalist worldview was a product of Europe’s inegalitarian past. The conservative, leisure-class’s desire to maintain the status quo was incorporated into a philosophy that favored eternal necessities over the temporal contingencies and the uncovering of static natures over the engagement with the dynamic processes. As such it stood in the way of growth and constructive change. By shifting attention away from traditional memes to those that focuses on the future, Dewey meant to reconstruct philosophy into the exercise of practical judgment, a dedication to the kinds of understanding that are geared to contemporary obstacles that obstruct the flow of expressive creativity. Rorty endorses Dewey’s intention.

As Rorty characterizes Dewey’s vision, Pragmatism would, for the first time, “put the intellectuals at the service of the productive class rather than the leisure class.” Theory is to be treated as an aid to practice, rather than practice being seen as defective theory. With the assent of practice, the distinctions characteristic of dualism, those between mind and matter, thought and action, and appearance and reality, blur and fall away. Following precisely on this notion is political egalitarianism. If there is not to be dualistic distinction in the abstract, then none should be manifested in practice. Rorty accepts that individual self-reliance ought to be exercised on a communal level. Dewey promotes philosophy as the art of the politically useful. His is a social democracy where the policies that bring social utility are the policies that are best. This is where theoretical creativity ties into Rortyan pragmatic hope: “that one should stop worrying about whether what one believes is well-grounded and start worrying about whether one has been imaginative enough to think up interesting alternatives to one’s present beliefs.” Rorty holds that this is uniquely possible for all citizens in a democratic environment, where the clash of memes can happen under an auspicious tolerance that suppresses to a minimum pain and humiliation and allow for a flourishing of diversity. This is where pragmatism fuses with utilitarian values. Rorty suggests that it is reasonable to offer persuasive rhetoric rather than the use of physical assault or its preludes of mockery and insult, because coming to terms with people will likely increase human happiness in the long run. That is, by keeping open the lines of communication, new and exciting projects for the betterment of our condition has the best chance to develop than if fear and intimidation are the norm. It is the establishment of conditions conducive for human happiness that is the utopian hope within the human heart.

e. Davidson on Truth and Meaning

Rorty had claimed (prior to Ramberg’s essay—see section 5b below) that there was no more of a gap between human psychology and biology than between biology and chemistry (“McDowell, Davidson, and Spontaneity”, 1998). This follows easily from his Deweyan take on Darwinism. Once we accept Dewey’s pragmatism, then the vocabularies that allegedly could distinguish between the human and the natural come under serious challenge. Different disciplines are founded to achieve different purposes. There is no way for a discipline to try to be more “adequate to the world” than any other when, with Rorty, one gives up on, say, Quine’s physicalism which ranks some vocabulary (physics) as ontologically superior to others. If we generalize this rejection, as Rorty does, then one is able to reject scientism, a position which holds that a descriptive practice’s success or failure depends on its capture of a determinative material reality. Once we abandon the idea that one vocabulary is best suited to express the intrinsic order of things, then the ability to express the truth through the use of one vocabulary but not another is due to the different focus of interest that each vocabulary has, and not because one excels beyond all others in the expression of facts. There is a flat, deontologized, playing field among different descriptive strategies. These strategies are tools in the pragmatist’s toolbox to be utilized under appropriate conditions of need-fulfillment. So, for instance, if psychology is rightly conceived as a different practice than, say, economics, it is a practice that is geared to achieve a particular outcome deemed as important by the discipline of psychology, but not necessarily to economics, or for that matter, physics, ethics, and so forth. Psychology is merely a different causal strategy which an individual may choose to engage “nature” to achieve a specific outcome. But no strategy can claim to have the unique language-strategy that gets things right. Rorty believes there is no “super-language” that achieves a more adequate description of our relation to something other than ourselves because all vocabularies merely describe our practices as we engage in a causal interaction with “reality” as understood through those practices.

This position is available to Rorty largely due to Donald Davidson’s argument against the content-scheme distinction. This distinction, common in all dualisms, is seen as necessary only when credence is given to there being disparate ontological realms—one containing beliefs, the other containing non-beliefs (for example, matters of fact). Truth then becomes the correct analysis of the non-causal relation between particular beliefs and specific non-beliefs. But Davidson argues that such a dichotomy lacks credibility. That there is a mysterious relation between human and the non-human which tertia such as “experience,” “sensory stimulation,” “the world,” and so forth, act as epistemological bridges is, according to Davidson, an illusion created by the endeavor to take language as a medium or an instrument used to define truth. Rorty explains that Davidson avoids this representationalist pitfall by understanding “true” in terms of one’s own linguistic know-how. The “language I know,” the way that one’s community copes with the environment in practice, is enough to erase the alleged schism between intentional objects (the objects that most of the rules of action of one’s—or some other—linguistic community are true of; that is, are good for dealing with) and their referents. This is Davidson’s “Principle of Charity.”

The central understanding that Rorty draws from Davidson’s notion of “radical translation” at the heart of the “Principle of Charity” is that we language-users have already the causal link established between our beliefs and their referent(s). There is no need to establish a connection, it is the human condition. This linkage allows us to get things for the most part correct and thus make most of our statements about the world true, and to recognize that any translation is a faulty translation which renders as wrong most of a speaker’s beliefs about the world. Rorty suggests that it follows that any wholesale gap between intentional objects and referents would be impossible since survival depended upon humanity’s pragmatic application of beliefs to the environment. This carries over to our own individual webs of belief. Most of anyone’s beliefs must be, on the whole, true. Rorty uses this insight to explain that though we cannot get outside our beliefs and our language to establish some test besides the coherence of our own or others’ webs of belief we can still speak objectively and have knowledge of a public world not of our personal design.

It is through a Davidsonian holistic view of language that Rorty, contra Davidson, takes “truth” as a misguided slide back into representationalism. For Davidson, truth is a transparent term that in itself does not explain anything but emerges when the rules for action causally interact successfully with the world. Rorty rejects all appeals to truth, Davidsonian or otherwise, in favor of social justification. Because there are no comprehensive barriers between oneself and the world, we are free to advance beliefs with the aim of persuading others as to their efficacy in obtaining the outcomes they most desire. This is how Rorty blends Davidson’s notion of radical translation with Dewey’s naturalism to yield Rorty’s neopragmatism.

4. Positions

a. Overview

The overarching theme of Rorty’s writing is a promotion of a thorough-going naturalism. Recognizing the value of the Enlightenment challenge to religious speculation, and its offering of a humanist philosophy in its place, Rorty argues that the Enlightenment program was never completed. It fell short of its goal by keeping one foot in the past. By substituting the notion of Truth as One in place of a monotheistic worldview, the Enlightenment reformers repeated the tradition’s error by continuing to seek non-human authority, now in the guise of what Wilfrid Sellers called “the Myth of the Given.” Holding that reality has an intrinsic nature, and by advancing the correspondence theory of truth, Enlightenment philosophers turned away from full-blown naturalism, ironically, in service to a scientific objectivity that required a radical separation of the observer from the observed. Rorty’s neopragmatism is meant to ameliorate this perceived shortcoming by rigorously following through on Immanuel Kant’s distinction between causality and justification.

Rorty holds that our relation with the environment is purely causal. However, the way in which we describe it—the linguistic tools we employ to cope with the recalcitrance of that environment in an effort to achieve our purposes and desires, as natural creatures in the natural world—determines how we understand that world. Once we are causally prompted to form a belief, justification may take place in a social world where, as Davidson notes, only a belief can justify a belief. In short, Rorty maintains that there can be no norms derived from the natural, but only from the social.

This position allows Rorty to reject scientism (the representationalist view that cleaves to the Myth of the Given) while endorsing the development of a fully-naturalized science as an extremely useful tool for prediction and control. It also opens the way for Rorty to advance naturalized democracy with confidence. Instead of seeking some underlying fact about human nature which is essential, ahistorical, and universalizable, Rorty proposes we seek the justifications that are relevant to a contextually embedded practice. The loss of the unconditionality associated with long-established notions of truth is actually a gain, pragmatically speaking. While truth is an aim that is unachievable due to its definitional ambivalence prior to commitment to action, justification is a recognizable (and contingent) goal that permits practical satisfaction without closing the door on future recalibrations in response to inevitable challenges to such justifications. The best way to allow for justification of a belief with no neutral standpoint, Rorty suggests, is to allow competing beliefs to be evaluated on their performance capabilities and not on their ability to ground themselves in universal validity. This leads directly to Rorty’s ethnocentricism.

The following are various positions Rorty takes in accordance with his project of New Pragmatism.

b. Philosophy: Neither Realism nor Antirealism

For Rorty one of the results of the merging of Dewey’s naturalism with Davidson’s view of truth is the dropping of the realist-anti-realist issue. One is always in touch with reality as a language user, thus the distinction between truth-conditions and assertibility-conditions dissolves. However, it is important to note that although we humans use language to engage the environment it does not make the process artificial, in the sense of language concealing a transcendent reality behind social constructs, or by its being in wholesale error concerning the inherent character of the natural world. Rorty writes in Objectivity, Relativism, and Truth (1991) that “Davidson, on my interpretation, thinks that the benefit of going ‘linguistic’ is that getting rid of the Cartesian mind is the first step toward eliminating the tertia which, by seeming to intrude between us and the world, created the old metaphysical issues in the first place.” He continues that once we dispense with the tertia that try to breach the now discredited scheme-content gap, the distinction between appearance (“useful fictions”) and reality (“objective facts”) disappears. What remain are one’s community practices unfolding in a seamless and endless process of reweaving webs of beliefs in response to current and future conditions. From his rejection of the realist-anti-realist distinction springs Rorty’s anti-essentialist nominalism and anti-foundationalism.

c. Anti-essential Nominalism

Related to Rorty’s rejection of what he characterizes as the false dichotomy between realism and antirealism, is his dismissal of all ideas of essentialism. The Neurath’s Boat thought experiment poses no problem for Rorty. Terms like “boat” or “self” are strictly linguistic in nature. That is, they do not refer to Platonic Forms or Aristotelian essences, but to linguistically constructed, intentional objects. Boats or selves may undergo complete change piece-by-piece and still maintain their identity if and only if there is social agreement about the continuance of such notions. What is radical in Rorty’s linguistic principle is that there is no ultimate difference between the human and the non-human “entities;” they are definable and redefinable “all the way down.” There is nothing standing under [sub-stance] or above to anchor the ever-evolving linguistic parsing of metaphors.

Similarly, reference to reflexive consciousness, the hallmark of unique and private Cartesian self distinct from all non-conscious objects is, for Rorty an illegitimate attempt to nest metaphysical assertions about the existence of a separate human mind in the epistemology of first-person, self-evident awareness. Equally illegitimate is the appeal to materialism common to scientism. Language that reduces consciousness to brain functions creates a vocabulary that attempts to explain mental events as happenings of material alteration. There is a metaphysical assumption in materialism that Rorty, as an anti-essentialist, cannot countenance: that there is a physical world that is “really there” adequate to the cause of the mental.

Neither a reductive materialist nor dualistic subjectivist, Rorty opts for nominalist-pragmatism. That materialists deal with reality is to be understood as their concentrating on the concepts and descriptors they find most useful to discuss. When dualists maintain that there is an awareness which stands distinct from that which is extended and non-conscious, it shows their stubborn commitment to the dead Cartesian metaphor. Descartes’ reconstruction of the world was designed to secure the study of physics in a religious environment hostile to its practice. To reify Descartes’ “mind as a mental eye” metaphor as that which “perceives” itself as a self-evident “given” is to misunderstand the application of language to personal experience. This is a major theme of Rorty’s Philosophy as the Mirror of Nature (1979), as captured in his “Antipodean Analogy.” It is a challenge and reminder to the reader that the way we speak about the mental can (and will at some future time) be radically reconceived. If there can be found nothing essential to the mental that extends beyond and grounds our description of it, the very process with which we seem most intimate, then it follows that there is nothing essential—non-linguistic—to the non-mental either. There is no essential constitution to our minds. Rorty declares that privacy, immediacy, introspectibility, intentionality, incorrigibility, and self-evidency can be redescribed in terms that do not involve subjectivism (see also “Dennett on Awareness”).

d. Anti-foundationalist Historicism

Rorty denies the utility of all foundational philosophies (for example, Cartesian clear and distinct ideas, Kantian a priori truths, and so forth) on the basis that they share with representationalism a belief that the mind is the “mirror of nature.” Once the metaphysical distinction between appearance and reality disappears, so too ought the need for a knowing subject with a special faculty for apodictic truth. Seen by Rorty as secular theories meant to identify the necessary grounding of knowledge previously provided by the Divine or natural order, foundationalisms of all stripes have in common the desire for the subject to escape temporality and contingency into a transcendent viewpoint capable of experiencing the power of truth (for example, “truth resists attempts to refute it”), pressing rational minds toward consensus. Thus, in Rorty’s opinion, the invention of the transcendent subject is an attempt to salvage epistemologically a relation to a metaphysical realm that has been abandoned by post-Kantian thinkers. He holds that foundationalists arbitrarily raise to the level of universal the mundane linguistic practices and social norms that have dominated minds at some moment and in some locale. Rorty rejects the cultural hegemony implied in foundationalist narratives, and by doing so asserts a historicist belief in the inescapable embeddedness of the human condition in the flux and flow of evolutionary change. There is, from his perspective, no neutral, ahistorical standpoint, no “God’s-eye viewpoint” from which to gain a Parmenidean perspective on what there is. What we can assent to is a plurality of standpoints that achieve social acceptance because of their utility in and for the here and now.

e. Ethnocentricism

A natural order of reason is one more “relic” of the idea that truth consists of correspondence to the intrinsic nature of things. Absent an ahistorical standpoint from which to judge the intrinsic nature of reality, there is no such thing as a proposition that is justified without qualification or an argument which will better approximate the truth per se. For Rorty, there is no natural context-independent reason which somehow heralds and underlies all descriptive vocabulary. He considers the idea of context-independent truth a misguided effort to hypostatize the adjective “true” by repackaging it in epistemological terms of the Platonic attempt to hypostatize the adjective ‘good.’ Only such hypostatization causes one to believe that there is a goal of inquiry beyond justification to relevant contemporary audiences. Rorty holds: “All reasons are reasons for a particular people, restrained by spatial, temporal, and social conditions.” When we have justified our beliefs to an audience considered pertinent, we need not make any further claims, universal or otherwise.

To insist on context-independence would be to endow reason with causal powers that enable a particular descriptive vocabulary to resist refutation regardless of time, place, and social conditions. Alternately, one could suppose an ideal audience with the ability to speak a privileged vocabulary that allows its speakers to escape human limits and achieve a God-like grasp of the totality of possibility. But Rorty insists that there is neither such an audience, nor a privileged vocabulary that provides a priori a language of justification with the potential to draw all mundane audiences into universal consensus. There are only diverse linguistic communities, each of which has its own final vocabulary and its shared context-embedded perspective on reality, a reality that is forever and already interpreted from that standpoint.

Since, from the Rortyan outlook, the reality-appearance distinction is a relic of our authoritarian ontotheological tradition—the transmutation of the extrinsic, non-human power (that must be submitted to) into the secularized intrinsic nature of reality that still carries with it all the authoritarian drawbacks inherent in the tradition’s outdated metaphor (for example, Habermasian “universal validity”)—then the secularized metaphor of power/submission ought to be discarded along with the remnants of its religious origin.

But Rorty does not want to throw out entirely the fruits of Western culture. To the contrary, he says that he is “lucky” to having been raised within this cultural tradition, especially because of its tendencies for critical analysis and tolerance. In this vein, Rorty responds to a Habermasian critique: “I regard it a fortunate historical accident that we find ourselves in a culture . . . which is highly sensitized to the need to go beyond (dogmatic borders of thought).” Nevertheless, he does not hold that his luck is any different from that felt by Germans who considered themselves fortunate to enroll in the Hitler Youth. It’s simply a chance matter as to which society one is born, and what set of beliefs is valued therein.

Carrying forward his naturalistic, Darwinian views, Rorty sees humans as creatures whose beliefs and desires are for the most part formed by a process of acculturation. With no non-relative criteria or standards for telling real justifications from merely apparent ones, it follows that there can be no teleological mechanism independent of specific social narratives to determine the socioethical superiority of one solidarity over another. Since we all acquire our moral identity and obligations from our native culture (the niche in which we find ourselves), why not embrace our own social virtues as valid and try to redefine the world in terms of them? This is Rorty’s argument for ethnocentricism; a position from which one “can give the notion such as ‘moral obligation’ a respectable, secular, non-transcendental sense by relativizing it to a historically contingent sense of moral identity.” And if this is a form of cultural relativism, so be it. Rorty does not fear relativism, since fear grows from the concern that there is nothing in the universe to hang onto except ourselves. This is his humanist point against the claim that reason transcends local opinion; there is only ourselves nested in the habits of action evolving over time into the current, contingent societal solidarities we find useful for achieving our purposes.

f. Philosophy as Metaphor

In line with Rorty’s nominalism is his idea of philosophy as metaphor. Once one abandons the search for truth and for a reality that is concealed behind the everyday world, the role of a social practice in the vanguard of cultural change and innovation (philosophical or otherwise) is, or ought to be, to liberate humanity from old metaphors that are rooted in superstition, mystification, and a religion-inspired mindset. He suggests that this can be done by offering new metaphors and reshaping vocabularies that will accommodate new, “abnormal” insights. In this function, philosophy will note the fears kindled by past practices as well as the hopes springing from the present, and reconcile them by avoiding ancient fallacies while projecting contemporary justified beliefs into the future. Key to this project is the acknowledgement that philosophical theories have tended to reify that which had been proposed in the past as useful metaphors. This cognitive “idolatry” is an outgrowth of the adoption of the correspondence theory of knowledge. Beginning with Plato’s use of perception to analogize the relation of the psyche to the Forms, philosophers have mistakenly tried to make a word-world connection in order to ground reality in thought. The trouble with this approach is that it causes one to look behind the vocabulary for a non-human entity or force which grounds its meaning in our consciousness. Rorty thinks that this representational scheme is wrongheaded because it confuses use for content. He holds that it is rather in the use of words that we come to grips with our ever-changing environment. Successful adaptation of metaphors to new conditions is more likely when one drops the expectation that words are made adequate by that environment, or a creative agency of that environment. It is left to humans to consciously fashion their own metaphors to cope with the world. Freed from the tyranny of locating and adopting a non-human vocabulary, human ingenuity and creativity will craft undreamt of possibilities as surely as Galileo reinvented our understanding of the “heavens” by jettisoning of the outmoded Aristotelian crystalline celestial metaphor, or as Thomas Kuhn reinvented our understanding of paradigms by recasting the Kantian idiom.

g. Anti-representational Metaphilosophy

Rorty’s anti-representationalism is closely associated with his anti-essential nominalism. While Rorty does not doubt that there is a reality that is recalcitrant to some (but not all) linguistic approaches (that is to say that not all attempts at constructing language-games prove useful to our local purposes work), he rejects that there can ever be a narrative that has a privileged viewpoint and/or has the final determination on “What there is.” Traditional Western Philosophy’s establishment of, alternately, rationalist, empiricist or transcendental worldviews to address the problem of depicting in words and ideas what is, in fact, does not so much outline a pattern of progress in expressing more adequate illustrations of reality; rather, it presents a history of the “idea idea” which Rorty holds as a red herring. Since the time of Plato, struggles over first principles have yielded academic debates that are seemingly endless attempts to characterize the world, but that are counterproductive to conversations aimed at changing the world. Rorty suggests that philosophers change the subject. Subject-changing is possible because there can be no common framework in which all minds participate. The possibility of different language-games offers a multitude of frameworks from which to choose, given Rorty’s anti-representational stance. No framework is more or less part of the fabric of the universe. Rather, dialogue ought to supersede certainty; interpretation to trump the search for truth. First-order philosophical search for a stable, final vocabulary that coherently captures the world in words or accurately corresponds to it drops out and is replaced with narrative-driven conversation. The plurality of interpretations that follows opens the way for an ever-evolving exchange concerning the function of proposed statements relative to a context; a series of pragmatic dialogues about what course of action is best fitted to a contemporary situation.

A special case stands out for Rorty’s anti-representationalist critique, that of scientism. Since the Enlightenment, objectivity via method has been the standard for scientific investigators. The systematic reading of the material world by those who are expert in the vocabulary of the sciences (that is, the quantification of observation statements) privileges these “rational” interpretations over all others. The assumption is that the universe is at its core a unified complex readily available for accurate and thorough analysis once one assumes the proper epistemological stance. And once taken that stance will build upon itself in an ever-increasing accumulation of objective knowledge. This optimistic progressivism is questioned by Rorty. Following Dewey’s dismissal of the dispassionate, autonomous knower of culturally neutral, objective knowledge, Rorty criticizes scientism’s image of the givenness of the world and the ability of scientists to discover the rational structures inherent in it. Viewing knowledge as an historical and cultural artifact, Rorty wishes to replace scientism’s systematic worldview with an “edifying” philosophy that treats science as just one among many non-privileged approaches, each of which projects sets of rules designed to bring about the well-being of a community. The choice of which of these approaches is most beneficial is the topic of the open-ended, interdisciplinary conversation favored by Rorty. Being free from teleological constraint, this sort of dialogue carries with it the expectation that convergent consensus is never possible; thus science cannot be the focal point of, or unique conduit for, an ever improving meeting of minds. Instead, Rorty considers all consensuses as contingent, partial, and on-going solidarities directed toward some specific practical outcome.

h. Pragmatic Pluralism

With no neutral ground from which to establish convergent consensus, all positions are competing ideas; presumed goods struggling for their existence. Thus, each is a live option until the practice is accepted by, or it is abandoned as non-workable for, a society. Appeals beyond the social environment have been eliminated by Rorty’s anti-foundational and anti-essential stances. Without a vocabulary that captures either the way the world is or a core human nature, there is never any possibility to locate a metaphysical foundation for truth. Equally unrealizable is a distinct epistemological platform from which to resolve differences between incongruent intuitions. Without transcendent or transpersonal standards, Liberal and Conservative narratives, atheist and fundamentalist ideologies, and realist and pragmatist approaches all vie equally for a cultural niche determining what works for a group at a given time. With everything unanchored and in flux, there is never a settled outcome, no final vocabulary that prevents the emergence of novel practices that threaten to eclipse the established ways of life. A plurality of metaphors thrives and in doing so upsets the settled, the canonical, the convergent consensus, keeping the conversation going. Rorty contends that it is the bruising competition among rival frameworks, including his own, that will result in a shakeout of the best framework fit for the times, around which will form a solidarity (albeit, contingently) of similarly-minded individuals. And the bounty of ideas, project, and programs will be surprisingly novel and astoundingly different.

i. Solidarities, Poets, and the Jeffersonian Strategy

The idea of a convergent consensus is built around the expectation that there is a grounding metaphysical standard “beyond” the flux of time, culture and circumstance, and that this standard has been the object of search for millennia. But to locate this standard, the seekers already must be at the consensus point which is being sought; they must already know what this is in order to find the real. Rorty considers this sort of Platonist reminiscence to be a vicious circle that assumes the consequent, i.e., that an objective point of view, in fact, exists. Even the Kantian attempt to circumvent this problem by asserting that we can have a priori knowledge of objects that we constitute ignores the troubling fact, according to Rorty, that Kant never explained how we have apodictic knowledge of the “constituting activities” of a transcendental ego. This attempt at self-foundation founders in another, more threatening way. In the placing of the “outer” into the “inner, constituting space,” the rational mind (seen as Reason itself) becomes the arbiter of cultural norms (“culture” being conceived as a collection of knowledge claims). Thus the discipline of philosophy becomes the keeper of the status quo, whose opinions and mode of thinking becomes the one true standard for any other discipline to measure itself against. However, Rorty emphatically denies that Philosophy as a discipline holds this crucial role. In fact, he argues that we should put aside the Kantian distinctions between disciplines as inegalitarian, and favor an open-mindedness based upon the Jeffersonian model of religious tolerance.

This Jeffersonian strategy, in line with Rorty’s historicist anti-foundationalism and anti-essentialist nominalism, is designed to encourage the abandonment of any claim of the discovery of an all-encompassing system of thought that serves as the legitimizer of all other practices. Seen as a remnant of the onto-theological period in human thinking, systematic philosophy suffers the same ills as traditional dogmatic theologies in that they both project as universal historically embedded, cultural values. The remedy that Rorty wishes to apply to this systematizing is to split public practices from private beliefs, treating all theories as narratives on par with each other, and to shelter edifying impulses toward poetic self-creativity from all pressures to conform. This dual strategy levels the playing field in the public sector, allowing unrestricted democratic dialogue between groups holding rival narratives (solidarities), while at the same time liberating creative thought from the normalizing restraints of the alleged privileged rationality asserted by Theological, Philosophical or Scientific solidarities. What is denied in Rorty’s Jeffersonian strategy is any universal commensuration in either the epistemological or metaphysical sphere, as well as the privilege of the rational in a supposed hierarchical system of reality. What is gained is the possibility for the expression of alternative, “abnormal” voices in the conversation of humankind, which, in potential, may prove to be persuasive enough to draw a growing number of adherents into its ranks, thereby creating a new solidarity better adapted to the contemporary environment, with its unique set of issues and requirements than are prior narratives. The evolution of unique narratives is progressive in the sense that each society and every era can discard encrusted customs and embrace novel practices that seem best in addressing the problems at hand. It is also contingent because there can be no final vocabulary that gets it right about human nature or the nature of existence. All is in play “all the way down” in an essence-less world where any foundational pretence to a harmony between the human subject and the objects of knowledge is eschewed, and where justification is confined to “beliefs that cannot swing free from the nonhuman environment.”

j. Non-reductive Materialism and the Self

Rorty sees the division between reductive materialism and subjectivism as a pseudo-problem originating with the Cartesian mind-body dualism. These incommensurate descriptions both pose as the sole truth on the subject of the nature of ontologically real objects. Wishing to “dedivinize” philosophy, science and discussions on the self, Rorty occasionally concentrates on the last of this troika in an effort to unsettle the western notion about an underlying substantial metaphysical center grounding existence. In his “Contingency of Selfhood,” Rorty defends contingencies and discontinuities of the “I” against realist thought. It is plausible that most Enlightenment thinkers could not fathom how inert matter and its motion could account for the first person experience of human consciousness. Rorty suggests that fear against the association of selfhood to the dying human animal may be a motivation for philosophers since Plato to posit a central essence for individuals. To this concern Rorty resorts to non-reductive materialism to explain away the mind-body issue that has concerned thoughtful people for the last four hundred years.

The use of descriptive vocabularies plays an important part in Rorty’s gloss on the human “self.” In his narrative, one vocabulary is centered on the description of physical objects and another is concerned with the discursive agent. The discursive agent may redescribe all objects, including him/herself, as subject in ever more “abnormal” terms without limits. Nevertheless, once a description is dedicated to a physicalist’s accounts of brain activity, it becomes incumbent upon the describing agent to note differences in human experience with a different vocabulary, vocabulary that does not assume the consequent concerning the alleged existence of the mind independent from the body. Rorty claims to do this by assigning parallel descriptions to both mind and brain without claiming that there is a center to either.

Whereas the brain can be redescribed as the continual reweaving of the electrical charges across the web of neural synapses, the mind can be redescribed as the constant reweaving of different beliefs and desires, redistributing truth values among the web of interlocking statements. Under Rorty’s description the brain is simply the amalgamation of synapses with no center, i.e., nothing that is independent of this agglomeration. Equally, Rorty holds that the mind is exactly a contingent network of beliefs and desires, having nothing at its core to which the bundled beliefs and desires adhere. It follows there is no self that has these mental elements, rather the self is these elements, and nothing more. Gone is the Cartesian tendency to reify the self and a material object as substantial in order to acknowledge that they each have causal effects. Gone is the mistaken idea of a self as an object represented to ourselves (for example, Descartes’ claim that he is a “thinking thing”). And gone also is the urge to completely separate the mental from the physical ontologically. There are two incommensurate descriptions of causal interaction. In this way, Rorty’s non-reductive materialist account of the self accords well with his nominalism, which rejects the sentence-fact dichotomy as firmly as his anti-essentialism rejects the subject-object split.

Of course, in keeping with Rorty’s narrative, there is no reason why one should limit the descriptions of the self, the mind, and the brain to Rorty’s vocabulary usage. If sometime in the future it serves the purpose of those who live at the time to redescribe Rorty’s account, say along strictly neuron-physiological lines that may accurately pair specific beliefs and desires to identifiable brain functions, then its utility would demand the adoption of this narrative. But until then, Rorty would argue for a holistic approach that does not seek a one-to-one identity between brain functions and mental occurrences, or a reduction of one to the other.

5. Critics

A philosophy that is controversial and iconoclastic as Richard Rorty’s is bound to have an abundance of critics. Space permits the consideration of only a few, those considered serious objections to his neopragmatism. Here is a representative sample of philosophers who pose challenges to key aspects of Rorty’s philosophy.

a. Hilary Putnam, John McDowell, and James Conant

Hilary Putnam doubts Rorty’s ability to sustain his claim to be a pragmatic realist. Turning to Rorty’s pivotal view of justification, Putnam, in Rorty and His Critics (Brandom: 2000), characterizes it as having two aspects: contextual and reforming. About the former, Putnam says that Rorty, by making justification a sociological matter, has apparently made a commitment to majority sentiment. Nevertheless, Putnam declares, by allowing that the majority can be wrong, Rorty is being either incoherent or illicitly introducing a standard that is independent of the social context. Knowing that Rorty rejects ahistorical foundations Putnam takes up the reformist aspect of Rortyan justification to see if Rorty can escape his apparent inconsistency. Rorty’s reformist position suggests that progress in talking and acting results not from being more adequate to some non-human (natural or transcendent) independent standard than one’s predecessors. Rather progress occurs because it seems to us to be clearly better. To this definition of progress Putnam responds that whether the outcome of some reform is deemed to be good or bad is logically independent from whether most people see it as a reform. Otherwise, the meaning of “progress” reduces to a subjective notion and “reform” to an arbitrary preference for a way of life. Therefore, the implication is that if we are to meaningfully use the terms “progress” and “reform,” there has to be better and worse non-subjective standards and norms. So it follows that there are non-sociological, objective ways to appreciate reality. Otherwise in a Rortyan anti-representationalist world of competing “stories” enabling one to cope or failing to help one cope with the “environment,” Rorty’s own narrative of redescriptions becomes one among many non-privileged, solipsistic perspectives, and thus loses its persuasive power.

James Conant and John McDonald complement Putnam’s position. James Conant argues that Rorty’s narrative, when taken to its logical conclusion ultimately undermines the tolerant, liberal, egalitarian society Rorty claims to value. Conant offers that a liberal democratic community must contain three internally-linked, non-transcendent concepts necessary for human voice: freedom, community, and truth. He argues that in the absence of this interlocking troika an alternative triad arises: the prevalence of solitude, uniformity, and an Orwellian doublethink. This latter threesome force upon those inculcated into such a social order barren conformity to meta-ideology that denies the very ability to reformulate language in ways that might threaten the veracity of that order. This is accomplished by relativizing truth; by reducing truth to the status of empty compliments and by utilizing cautionary doubt as a method by which each individual replaces inconvenient memories with group ‘justified’ assertions.

John McDowell refines Putnam’s position, by offering a distinction that actually makes Rorty, Putnam, and Kant allies! He attempts this difficult association by distinguishing the fear of a contingent life and the subsequent appeal to a Freudian father-like force that provides us iron-clad answers and norms to live up to from the desire to have us answerable to the way things are. McDowell suggests that Kant too wished to combat the denial of human finitude, and the consequent withdrawal from the contingent into the safety of an eternal realm, by claiming that appearance was not a barrier preventing us from gazing at reality objectively, but is the very reality we as rational human beings aspire to know. In this way McDowell thinks that Kant, admittedly anti-metaphysical, was as anti-priesthood as Dewey—extending the Protestant Reformation’s idiosyncratic connection to a non-human reality into Philosophy—and in line with Rorty’s anti-epistemology stance—that we are always ensconced within the human frame of reference. The upshot of McDowell’s distinction of objectivity from epistemic escapism is that even as we are located inextricably within a vocabulary there can be joined a unified discourse where the combination of a disquotational, descriptive use of the word “true” and the use of “true” that treats this term as a norm of inquiry is possible.

Conant builds Putnam’s and McDowell’s arguments for the ascendancy of objectivity (properly understood) over solidarity by linking Orwell’s “Newspeak” and Rorty’s New Pragmatism. Conant constructs his argument first by offering the non-controversial claim that freedom of belief is achievable only when one can decide for oneself concerning the facts in a community that nurtures this sort of freedom. This community can only be sustained when its norms of inquiry are not biased toward lock-step solidarity with one’s peers, but are geared toward the encouragement of independent attempts at relating one’s claims about the way things are with the way things are, in fact (or as Conant writes: ‘turning to the facts’). Real human freedom can be expressed when one is able to autonomously believe and to test one’s belief for its truth and falsity in a public forum unconstrained by sociological determinants. Freedom, Conant claims, is therefore a human capacity that emerges from the human condition and need not be attributable to any Realist thesis. Thus, Conant agrees with Rorty that there is nothing deep within us; there isn’t any indestructible nature or eternal substance. Nevertheless, a systematic effort to eliminate the vocabulary containing terms such as ‘eternal truths,’ ‘objective reality,’ and traits ‘essential to humanity’ would be akin to George Orwell’s Newspeak, in that such an elimination would render impossible human freedom by making it impossible to share in language such ideas and concepts. The very possibility of interpretive communication and dialogue among free thinkers engaged in the search for truth would be banished by the sort of control exerted over language that Rorty ironically insists is necessary to change vocabularies and to establish a liberal democratic utopia.

b. Donald Davidson and Bjorn Ramberg

Donald Davidson combines the theory of action with the theory of truth and meaning. For him an account of truth is simultaneously an account of agency and vice versa. By referring to “rationality,” “normativity,” “intentionality,” and “agency” as if they were co-extensive predicates, Davidson is able to claim that descriptions emerge as descriptions of any sort only against a taken-for-granted background of purposeful action. Agency—the ability to offer descriptions rather than merely make noise—only appears if a normative vocabulary is already in use. Normative behavior on the part of the communicators involved makes the case that the intentional stance is unlike the biological stance. In Rorty and His Critics, Davidson raises the “underdetermination/radical interpretation” issue, disputing Rorty’s long-held pragmatic claim that there is no significant philosophical difference between the psychological and the biological, as there is no significant difference between the biological and the chemical, once we abandon the idea of “adequacy to the world.”

Bjorn Ramberg, in support of Davidson’s contention in “Post-ontological Philosophy of Mind: Rorty Versus Davidson,” suggests that the linkage between mind and body is not the irreducibility of the intentional to the physical, but the understanding of the inescapability of the normative. Considering each other as persons with mutual obligations presupposes all pragmatic choices of descriptive vocabularies. We could never deploy some descriptive narrative unless we first deployed a normative vocabulary. As followers of norms, we cannot stop prescribing and just describe. Describing is part and parcel of a rule-governed conversation, an exchange conducted by people who talk to each other assuming the vocabulary of agency. Thus, members of a community are to be considered as interlocutors and not as “parametrics” (causal happenings). Rorty is correct in that there are many descriptive vocabularies (ways to bring salience to different causal patterns of the world) and many different communities of language-users. Yet, until recently, Rorty did not accept Davidson’s position that all individuals who engage others in descriptive language-use must speak prescriptively (see section 3e above), or that it is the inescapability of the vocabulary of normality (rather than the claims about the irreducibility of intentionality, rejected by Rorty) that marks off agency from biology. This leads directly to Davidson’s Doctrine of Triangulation. We are a plurality of agents (one corner of a triangle) each engaged in the project of describing to each other the “world” (a second corner), and interpreting each other’s descriptions of it (the third corner). As Ramberg writes:

We can while triangulating criticize any given claim about any description, we cannot ask for an agreement on the process of triangulation itself, for it would be another case of triangulation. The inescapability of norms is the inescapability—for both the describers and agents—of triangulation.

Davidson’s insight, as elucidated by Ramberg, has caused Rorty to revise his view that norms are set within solidarities alone. Rorty now holds that norms hover, so to speak, “over the whole process of triangulation.” While he still does not accept the positing of a second norm of factual reality as suggested by John McDowell, the emergent property of norms springing from dialogue cannot be reduced to, or identified with its biological (in a fashion similar to flocking, schooling, etc) or chemical (like H2O from hydrogen and oxygen, and so forth) counterparts.

c. Daniel Dennett

Daniel Dennett, in “Faith in the Truth” and “Postmodernism and Truth,” rejects postmodern critiques of physicalist science. Dennett’s target is relativism. Specifically, he charges that Rorty’s stance against the “chauvinism of scientism” leads to blurring the line between serious scientific debate and frivolous historicist exchanges that include science merely as one of many voices in the conversation of humankind. Thus, there is a danger in jettisoning “the matter of fact versus no matter of fact distinction.” What is lost is the ability to make true assertions about reality in terms other than the sociological. Dennett objects to the postmodern notion that what is true today—that leads us to assert, for example, that DNA is a double helix—may not be true tomorrow if the conversation shifts. Rather, he claims that there are actual justifications of what certain sociological facts obtain when it comes to the natural sciences (that is, that there is more agreement among scientists, that the scientific language-game is a better predictor of future events than other vocabularies, and so forth). To confirm our observations we must form good representations of reality. This is what allows these representations to be justified, beyond being good tools that lead to further coping strategies vis-à-vis nature. Otherwise, Rorty’s attitude—expressed as “give us the tools, make the moves, and then say whatever you please about their representational abilities. . . (f)or what you say will be, in the pejorative sense, ‘merely philosophical’”—dismisses scientific objectivity while aiding and abetting postmodern relativists who threaten to replace theory with jargon. Dennett considers writers holding such attitudes to be in “flatfooted ignorance of the proven methods of scientific truth-seeking and their power.”

d. Jurgen Habermas, Nancy Fraser, and Norman Geras

Jürgen Habermas writes in “Richard Rorty’s Pragmatic Turn,” “In forfeiting the binding power of its judgments, metaphysics also loses it substance.” With its loss philosophy can be rescued from its drift only by a post-metaphysics “metaphysics.” This is what Rorty is attempting to do. In his hands, philosophy must become more than academic; it must become relevant in a practical way. Recasting Heidegger in post-analytic terms, Rorty see the deflationary trends in contemporary philosophy as leading to its own negation if left unchecked by edifying creativity. It is a pattern that can lead to extinction if there is not new life breathed into old metaphors by restating them, stripped of their Platonic bias. Central to this bias, according to Habermas’ understanding of Rorty, is the Platonic distinction between “convincing” and “persuading.” Rorty wishes to replace the representational model of knowledge with a communication model that means to replace objectivity with successful intersubjective solidarity. But, Habermas contends that the vocabulary which Rorty employs blurs the line between participant and observer. By assimilating interpersonal relationships into adaptive, instrumental behaviors, Rorty cannot distinguish between the use of language directed towards successful actions and its use oriented toward achieving understanding. Without a conceptual marker to distinguish manipulation from argumentation, “between motivating through reason and causal exertion of influence, between learning and indoctrination,” Habermas concludes that Rorty’s project results in a loss of critical standards that make a real difference in our everyday practices.

Nancy Fraser provides in her “From Irony to Prophecy to Politics: A Response to Richard Rorty” a Habermasian case of Rorty’s difficulty in distinguishing between edification and indoctrination. While Fraser is sympathetic to Rorty’s anti-essentialist stance and his linguistic turn relative to politics and power, she has objected to his depiction of the process he suggests for the advancement of causes, Feminist or otherwise. In her response to Rorty’s “Feminism and Pragmatism,” Fraser rejects the notion advanced by Rorty that women must make a complete break with the memes that have been employed by males in Western cultures and redefine themselves out of whole cloth. The reason she gives for her objection is that the neo-Darwinian revolutionary vision that Rorty offers to Feminism is itself too embedded in the chauvinism of the past. Likening the suggested redefinition of memes to form a new feminist solidarity to the Oedipal struggle between a son and his father—manifested in the need for women to confront and overthrow those males who currently assert their semantic authority—Fraser dismisses Rorty’s zero-sum-game struggle over semantic space as one that replicates the male competitive model and does not easily fit into the psychological profile of pluralist, communal dialogue that contemporary feminists favor.

Furthermore, Fraser questions the notion of women forming solidarities, or as Rorty puts it “feminist clubs,” for the purpose of redefining themselves. She wonders which of the various definitions (for example, radical, liberal, Marxist, socialist, traditionalist, and so forth) will count as “taking the viewpoint of women as “women”? Would this not be an imposition of semantic authority by one elite, privileged “club” onto all other women? And would this not be a return to the Oedipal, confrontational style she is rejecting by inflaming the definitional differences among women along masculinist lines of class, sexual preference, and racial categories? Therefore, Fraser wants there to be a political movement along the lines of democratic socialism, where the various voices of women (and other feminists) move to create (and not discover or be assigned even in the most supportive terms) their own post-rationalist meanings, thus empowering women to speak for themselves, not as “prophets” but as themselves.

Similarly, Norman Geras takes exception to Rorty’s liberalism and his democracy of hope. Geras’s “Solidarity in the Conversation of Humanity (1995) is concerned with the possibility (more to the point, the impossibility) of a (Deweyan) humanism without any human nature. In this work, Geras refers to a lecture given by Rorty in the 1993 Oxford Amnesty series on “Human Rights”: the culture of human rights is, Rorty says, a “welcome fact of the post-Holocaust world”; it is “morally superior to other cultures.” Such affirmations, Geras notes, are part of the more general viewpoint Rorty recommends to western cultures: the viewpoint of liberalism without philosophical foundations, a pragmatically inspired hope for a tolerant and open democratic society on the basis of historical contingencies only. But in answering Geras’ rhetorical question “To whose morality is Rorty referring?” it seems, at first glance, that Rorty would answer that it is the solidarity of western liberal individuals’ values. Upon reflection, however, it would be a surprise if most of these liberals agreed with Rorty’s view on the denatured self and the ungroundedness of supporting humanitarian principles. Therefore, with principles being ad hoc adaptations of past ethnocentric norms and without the firm peg of a centered self upon which to hang his web of beliefs, Rorty has to be advancing his own idiosyncratic values. Furthermore, his values are packaged persuasively by the artful use of equivocations, allegedly as part and parcel of the human right’s culture based on a universalist notion of transcultural human integrity, notions that Rorty stoutly rejects. In short, Rorty’s reading of the human rights culture appropriates the notion of rights for his own anti-foundational, pragmatic ends: the command of semantic space of his view of humanity’s future. By doing so, Geras contends, in line with Habermas, there can be no clear distinction between the Rortyan democratic contribution to a dialogue on human ideals and a subtle insinuation of his idiosyncratic viewpoint into everyday practices making the world in his own image.

6. References and Further Reading

a. Works by Rorty

Rorty, Richard, Ed., The Linguistic Turn: Essays in Philosophical Method. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1967.
Rorty, Richard. Philosophy and the Mirror of Nature. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1979.
Rorty, Richard. Consequences of Pragmatism. Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press, 1982.
Rorty, Richard. Contingency, Irony, and Solidarity. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1989.
Rorty, Richard. Objectivity, Relativism, and Truth: Philosophical Papers, Volume 1. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1991.
Rorty, Richard. On Heidegger and Others: Philosophical Papers, Volume 2. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1991.
Rorty, Richard. Truth and Progress: Philosophical Papers, Volume 3. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1998.
Rorty, Richard. Achieving our Country: Leftists Thoughts in Twentieth-Century America. Cambridge, Massachusetts: Harvard University Press, 1998.
Rorty, Richard. “McDowell, Davidson, and Spontaneity.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 58: 2, (June, 1998): 389-394.
Rorty, Richard. Philosophy and Social Hope. London: Penguin Books, 1999.
Rorty, Richard. Take Care of Freedom and Truth Will Take Care of Itself: Interviews with Richard Rorty. Ed., Edwuardo Mendieta. Stanford: Sanford University Press, 2006.

b. Works about Rorty

Brandom, Robert B., ed. Rorty and His Critics. Oxford: Blackwell Publishing, 2000.
Calder, Gideon. Rorty and Redescription. London: Weidenfeld & Nicolson, 2003.
Geras, Norman. Solidarity in the Conversation of Humanity. London: Verso, 1995.
Goodman, Russell B., ed. Pragmatism: A Contemporary Reader. New York: Routledge, 1995.
Hall, David L. Richard Rorty: Prophet and Poet of the New Pragmatism. Albany: State University of New York Press, 1994.
Malachowski, Alen, ed. Reading Rorty. Oxford: Basil Blackwell, 1990.
Murphy, John P. Pragmatism: From Peirce to Davidson. Boulder Colorado: Westview Press, 1990.
Saatkamp, Herman J., ed. Rorty & Pragmatism: The Philosopher Responds to His Critics. Nashville, Tennessee: Vanderbilt University Press, 1995.

c. Further Reading

Darwin, Charles. The Origin of the Species. New York: Random House, 1979.
Davidson, Donald. Inquiries Concerning Truth and Interpretation. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1984.
Dennett, Daniel. Consciousness Explained. New York: Little, Brown, 1991.
Dewey, John. The Quest for Certainty. New York: Capricorn Books, 1960.
Habermas, Jurgen. The Philosophical Discourse of Modernity. Tr., Frederick G. Lawrence. Cambridge, Massachusetts: The MIT Press, 1992.
Hegel, G. W. F. Phenomenology of Spirit. Tr., A. V. Miller. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1977.
Heidegger, Martin. Being and Time. Translators John Macquarrie and Edward Robinson. New York: Harper & Row, 1962.
Kuhn, Thomas. The Structure of Scientific Revolutions. Chicago: Chicago University Press, 1962.
Putnam, Hilary. Words and Life. Cambridge, Massachusetts: Harvard University Press, 1994.
Quine, Willard. V. O., Word and Object. Cambridge, Massachusetts: The MIT Press, 1960.
Sellars, Wilfrid. Science, Perception and Reality. New York: Humanities Press, 1963.

Author Information

Edward Grippe
Email: EGrippe@ncc.commnet.edu
Norwalk Community College
U. S. A.

Gregory of Nyssa (c. 335—c. 395 C.E.)

Gregory_of_Nyssa Gregory of Nyssa spent his life in Cappadocia, a region in central Asia Minor. He was the most philosophically adept of the three so-called Cappadocians, who included brother Basil the Great and friend Gregory of Nazianzus. Together, the Cappadocians are credited with defining Christian orthodoxy in the Eastern Roman Empire, as Augustine (354—430 C.E.) was to do in the West. Gregory was a highly original thinker, drawing inspiration from the pagan Greek philosophical schools, as well as from the Jewish and Eastern Christian traditions, and formulating an original synthesis that was to influence later Byzantine, and possibly even modern European, thought. A central idea in Gregory’s writing is the distinction between the transcendent nature and immanent energies of God, and much of his thought is a working out of the implications of that idea in other areas–notably, the world, humanity, history, knowledge, and virtue. This leads him to expand the nature-energies distinction into a general cosmological principle, to apply it particularly to human nature, which he conceives as having been created in God’s image, and to rear a theory of unending intellectual and moral perfectibility on the premise that the purpose of human life is literally to become like the infinite nature of God.

Life
God
World
Humanity
History
Knowledge
Virtue
Conclusion
References and Further Reading

1. Life

Gregory of Nyssa was born about 335 C.E. in Cappadocia (in present-day Turkey). He came from a large Christian family of ten children–five boys and five girls. Gregory’s family is significant, for two of the most influential people on his thought are two of his elder siblings–his sister Macrina (c.327—379) and Basil (c.330—379), the oldest boy in the family. Along with Basil and fellow-Cappadocian and friend Gregory of Nazianzus (c.329—c.391), Gregory of Nyssa forms the third of a trio of Christian thinkers, collectively known as the Cappadocians, who established the main lines of orthodoxy in the Christian East. Basil, who became the powerful bishop of Caesarea, was the most politically skilled churchman of the group. He appointed his younger brother to the see by which he is now known, and rightly predicted that Gregory would confer more distinction on the obscure town of Nyssa than he would receive from it. Gregory of Nazianzus was a brilliant orator, best known for his five “theological orations,” which succinctly summarized the Cappadocian consensus. But the deepest thinker of the three was Gregory of Nyssa. Gregory stands at a crossroads in the theological development of the Christian East: he sums up many of the ideas of his great predecessors, such as the Jewish philosopher Philo of Alexandria (c.20 B.C.E.—c.54 C.E.) and the Christian Origen (c.185—254 C.E.), and initiates the development of themes that will appear in the most prominent of the later Byzantine thinkers, notably the Pseudo-Dionysius (c.500) and Gregory Palamas (1296 – 1359).

As the eldest boy, Basil was the only one of Gregory’s siblings to receive a formal education. So Basil in all probability became the teacher of his younger brother. If so, he certainly did an excellent job, for in this case the pupil went on to outshine the teacher. Gregory is thoroughly at home with the philosophers that were in vogue in his day: Plato (427—347 B.C.E.)—especially as “updated” and systematized by Plotinus (204 – 270 CE)–Aristotle (384 – 322 BCE), and the Stoics. On reading his works, one cannot but be struck by the abundance of allusions to the Platonic dialogues. Yet it would be a mistake to say, as Cherniss famously does, that “Gregory . . . merely applied Christian names to Plato’s doctrine and called it Christian theology” (The Platonism of Gregory of Nyssa: 62). As will be seen below, there is a pronounced linear view of history in Gregory’s thought, which can only be of Hebrew provenance. Moreover, the reader will discover an originality in Gregory that anticipates not only his Byzantine successors, but also such moderns as John Locke (1632 – 1704) and Immanuel Kant (1724 – 1804).

The turning point in Gregory’s life came about 379, when both his brother Basil and his sister Macrina died. The burning issue at the time was the Arian heresy, which by then had entered its last and most logically rigorous phase. Arianism was a Christological heresy, named for its founder Arius (c. 256 – 336), that held that Christ was neither divine nor human, but a sort of demigod. The principal defender of Arianism at the time, Eunomius of Cyzicus (c. 325 – c. 394), argued that the Arian doctrine could even be derived from the very concept of God, as will be seen below. For most of this period, the brunt of the battle for orthodoxy had been led by Basil; but when he died, and shortly thereafter Gregory’s beloved sister, Gregory felt that the responsibility for defending orthodoxy against the Arian heresy had fallen on his shoulders. Thus began the most productive period of one of the most brilliant of Christian thinkers–far too little known and appreciated in the West.

That period was launched by the publication of his Against Eunomius, Gregory’s four-book refutation of that last phase of the Arian heresy. It was followed by many more works, the most significant being On the Work of the Six Days, Gregory’s account of the creation of the world; On the Making of Man, his account of the creation of humankind; The Great Catechism, the most systematic statement of Gregory’s philosophy of history; On the Soul and the Resurrection, a dialogue with Macrina detailing Gregory’s eschatology; Biblical commentaries on the life of Moses, the inscriptions of the Psalms, Ecclesiastes, the Song of Songs, the Beatitudes, and the Lord’s Prayer; theological works on Trinitarian and Christological doctrine; and shorter ascetic and moral treatises. Many of these will be discussed below.

Gregory was present at the final defeat of Arianism in the Council of Constantinople of 381. Nothing more is heard from him after about 395 CE.

2. God

Gregory’s concept of God is born out of the Arian controversy. Arianism arose out of the need to make sense of the apparently conflicting Biblical depictions of Christ. For example, how is one to understand Jesus’ claim that “I and the Father are one” (John 10:30) when it seems to be contradicted by the admission that “the Father is greater than I” (John 14:28)? This sort of problem prompted Arius to postulate that Christ was neither divine nor human, but something in between–a demigod, the oldest and most perfect created being, to be sure, but created nonetheless. By Gregory’s day, the leading spokesman for Arian theology was Eunomius of Cyzicus, who argued for Arianism on strictly philosophical grounds. The created nature of Christ could be derived by an analysis of the very concept of God, Eunomius argued; for it is God’s essential nature to be unbegotten, whereas Christ is confessed to be “begotten of the Father.” If this sort of argument were allowed to stand, what was to become the orthodox faith–the faith enunciated at Nicaea in 325 CE that Christ was literally “of the same substance” with the Father–would be radically transformed.

Gregory counters Eunomius, not by simply staking out the opposite position and defending it with Scriptural artillery, as most of his fellow Nicenes had done, but, more interestingly, by repudiating the central presupposition of Eunomian theology–that one can derive by a process of analysis concepts that are essentially predicated of God. God is incomprehensible; thus, it is presumptuous in the extreme to suppose that God can be defined by a set of human concepts. When we are speaking of God’s inner nature, all that we can say is what that nature is not (Against Eunomius II [953 – 960, 1101 – 1108], IV 11 [524]). In saying this, Gregory anticipates the negative theology of the Pseudo-Dionysius and much medieval thought.

Nevertheless, if that were the whole story–if we were left with God’s utter incomprehensibility and nothing more–then Gregory’s theology would be a very much stunted exposition of Christianity. After all, in the Beatitudes Christ promises, “Blessed are the pure in heart, for they shall see God.” (Matt. 5:8) If God’s inner nature is knowable only negatively, how is this possible? More generally, if God is simply some remote, unknowable entity, what possible relation to the world could God ever have? Gregory answers these questions by distinguishing between God’s nature (phusis) and God’s “energies” (energeiai)–the projection of the divine nature into the world, initially creating it and ultimately guiding it to its appointed destination (Beatitudes VI [1269]). The idea of God’s energies in Gregory’s theology approximates to the Western concept of grace, except that it emphasizes God’s actual presence in those parts of creation which are perfected just because of that presence. By distinguishing between God’s nature (sometimes he uses the word “substance”–ousia) and God’s energies, Gregory anticipates the more famous substance-energies distinction of the fourteenth century Byzantine theologian Gregory Palamas.

Does all of this have any sort of rational basis? Though he frequently appeals to Scripture to support his claims, Gregory does in fact argue for the existence of God. And although he concedes that God’s inner nature will always remain a mystery to us, Gregory holds that we can attain some knowledge of God’s energies. This does not mean, however, that God does not have a transcendent nature. As will be seen below, for Gregory everything that exists has an inner nature that cannot be known immediately and is knowable only through its energies. God is only the most striking instance of this. If it can be shown that God exists, it follows necessarily in Gregory’s mind that God has a nature. But God’s existence is derived from our knowledge of God’s energies, and those energies are in turn known both indirectly and directly.

The indirect route relies on the order apparent in the cosmos. The fact that the universe is orderly indicates that it is governed according to some rational plan, which implies the existence of a divine Planner (Against Eunomius II [984 – 985, 1009, 1069]; Great Catechism Prologue [12], 12 [44]; Work of the Six Days [73]; Life of Moses II 168 [377 – 380]; Ecclesiastes I [624], II [644 – 645]; Song of Songs I [781 – 784], XI [1009 – 1013], XIII [1049 – 1052]; Beatitudes VI [1268]). In noting this, Gregory is relying on an argument that had been around since the early Stoics–the argument from design (cf. Cicero, Nature of the Gods II 2.4 – 21.56). Now there are several things to notice about this argument. In the first place it is an analogical one: just as a work of art leads us to infer the existence of an artist, so the artistry displayed in the order of nature suggests the existence of a Creator. But if Gregory’s argument is nothing more than a generalized appeal to the harmony of the universe, it is not a very persuasive basis for proving the existence of God. For that there are laws of nature is nothing surprising: to have anything at all, from cosmos to quark, is to have order. If this is all that Gregory means, his argument at best reduces to the cosmological, or “first cause,” argument that any chain of creating or sustaining causes requires a first member, which “everyone would call God,” as Thomas Aquinas puts it (Summa Theologiae I q. 2 a. 3). Such an argument, however, is not very convincing. Why not an infinite chain of causes, for instance? Or even more to the point, why can’t things exist on their own? It doesn’t seem that the cosmological argument rules out either of these two possibilities.

However, what Gregory has in mind seems to be something more specific. In certain passages Gregory suggests that it is not order in general but the blending of opposites into a harmonious whole that would have never happened spontaneously, but only through the power of a Creator. The heavens accommodate contrary motions, and these motions give rise to unmoving, static laws (Inscriptions of the Psalms I 3 [440 – 441]); heavy bodies are borne downward and light bodies upward, and simple causes bring about complex effects (Soul and Resurrection [25 – 28]). In all these situations opposites not only fail to annihilate each other, but they even contribute to an overall harmony. The emphasis here is not on order in general, but on unexpected order. Given what we know about motion and rest, heaviness and lightness, and the rest, Gregory argues, we would expect to find them excluding, rather than complementing, each other. The fact that they behave in unanticipated ways can only be explained by the exercise of divine power.

Now one could object at this point that these phenomena are by no means surprising; they are surprising to Gregory only because the scientific knowledge of the fourth century is not as advanced as that of the twenty-first. However, it is not all that difficult to abstract the general point from Gregory’s particular examples and to bring his argument up-to-date by replacing motion and rest, heaviness and lightness, and so forth with modern examples of phenomena that cannot be explained by any known law of physics (the “lumpiness” of the universe, for example). Yet our hypothetical objector still has a point, as is particularly obvious to us who are examining the thought of a fourth century figure seventeen centuries later. The fact that a phenomenon seems to violate what we think we know of the laws of nature does not imply that it really does violate those laws. Our knowledge may simply be too limited. So the fact that we find order in nature that we don’t expect may simply be a function of the limitation of our knowledge rather than of the intervention of God in the world.

The direct method whereby God’s energies are known is by examining our own moral purification. It was observed above that Gregory’s concept of the divine energies is very similar to the Western concept of grace, except that for Gregory, as for Eastern thinkers in general, grace is due to the actual presence of God and not some action at a distance. As Gregory puts it, “Deity is in everything, penetrating it, embracing it, and seated in it” (Great Catechism 25 [65]). So we directly experience the divine energies in the only thing in the universe that we can view from within–ourselves. But God’s energies are always a force for good. Thus we encounter them in the experience of virtues such as purity, passionlessness, sanctity, and simplicity in our own moral character: “if . . . these things be in you,” Gregory concludes, “God is indeed in you” (Beatitudes VI [1272]).

Some scholars (for example, Balas, Metousia Theou, p. 128) argue that for Gregory energeiai should be translated “operations” rather than “energies,” thus bringing Gregory’s concept of God’s energeiai more into line with Aquinas’ concept of God’s power (Summa Theologiae I qq. 8, 25), or of God’s effects (cf. Summa Theologiae I q. 2, a. 2; q. 12, a. 12). But such an interpretation will not do for two reasons. First, Gregory insists that God exists in God’s energeiai just as much as in God’s nature (Against Eunomius I 17 [313], cf. Letter to Xenodorus). He could not say that if God’s energeiai were merely God’s operations. Second, it was shown above that Gregory uses the concept of God’s energeiai to explain how the “pure in heart” can “see God.” Once again, one cannot “see God” in God’s operations, except in a metaphorical sense; but one can literally “see God” with the spiritual sense of sight (on the spiritual senses, see below) if God is, as Gregory claims, actually “present within oneself” (Beatitudes VI [1269]).

3. World

Gregory’s account of the creation of the world reflects the nature-energies logic developed in his polemic against Eunomius. The account unfolds via an allegorical reflection on the first chapter of Genesis, and closely follows the much earlier work of Philo of Alexandria. Like Philo (Creation of the World 3.13), Gregory does not take literally the temporal sequence depicted therein; rather, he envisions creation as having taken place all at once (Work of the Six Days [69 – 72, 76]). Within this atemporal framework, the key “event” was the creation of the firmament on the second day (Work of the Six Days [80 – 85]), for it is the firmament that divides the intelligible world, created on the first day (Work of the Six Days [68 – 85]), from the sensible world, created on days three through six (Work of the Six Days [85 – 124])–again, broadly similar to Philo (Creation of the World 7.29 – 10.36, 44.129 – 44.130). Now the intelligible world was by Gregory’s day pictured as a pleroma of Platonic forms existing as ideas in the mind of God; for ever since the advent of Middle Platonism in the first century BCE, the Platonic forms had been transmuted from self-subsistent entities (as Plato conceived them) to ideas in the divine mind. The classic problem with this view, going as far back as Plato himself, was to explain how these forms become instantiated in the material world.

Gregory recasts this problem in theological terms: how could God, who is immaterial, have created the material world? The answer lies in the Aristotelian distinction between the category of substance and the other categories–relation, quality, quantity, place, time, action, passion (Categories 1 – 9)–which Gregory designates with the Stoic term “qualities” (poiotetes). In themselves, qualities are ideas in the mind of God. But they can also be projected out from God; and when that happens, they become visible. Now Gregory observes that although we ordinarily speak of these immanent qualities as inhering in substances, all we really perceive are the qualities of things, not their substances. It is but a short step to the conclusion that a physical object is nothing more than the convergence of its qualities. Thus matter as such doesn’t really exist; bodies are really just “holograms” formed by this convergence of qualities. Consequently there is no problem of how an immaterial God could have created a material world, for the world isn’t material at all (Against Eunomius II [949]; Work of the Six Days [69]; Making of Man 24 [212 – 213]; Soul and Resurrection [124]).

Elsewhere, Gregory explicitly uses the term “energies” to cover those qualities that are immanent in the physical world. Energies, Gregory contends, are the “powers” and “movements” by which substances are “manifested”; the energy of each thing is its “distinguishing property” (idioma)–a technical Stoic term for a specific, as opposed to a generic, quality. Gregory goes so far as to assert that apart from its energies a nature not only cannot be known, but does not even exist. (Letter to Xenodorus).

Gregory’s position bears a curious resemblance to that of John Locke; for according to Locke we know only the nominal essences of things, not their real essences. Thus substance is a “something . . . we know not what” (Essay II xxiii 3). All we really know of substances are their attributes, which constitute their nominal essences (Essay II xxxi 6 – 10, III iii 15 – 19). In this light consider the following passage from Against Eunomius:

Even the inquiry as to that thing in the flesh itself which assumes all the corporeal qualities has not been pursued to any definite result. For if any one has made a mental analysis of that which is seen into its component parts, and, having stripped the object of its qualities, has attempted to consider it by itself, I fail to see what will have been left for investigation. For when you take from a body its color, its shape, its hardness, its weight, its quantity, its position, its forces active or passive, its relation to other objects, what remains that can still be called a body, we can neither see of ourselves nor are taught by Scripture. . . . Wherefore also, of the elements of this world we know only so much by our senses as to enable us to receive what they severally supply for our living. But we possess no knowledge of their substance . . . . (Against Eunomius II [949])

In Gregory’s account of creation, the nature-energies distinction, developed to counter Eunomius’ defense of the Arian heresy, becomes extended into a general cosmological principle. The most important consequence of this extension is its application to the capstone of the cosmic order–human nature.

4. Humanity

The fundamental fact about human nature according to Gregory of Nyssa is that humans were created in the image of God. This means that because in God a transcendent nature exists which projects energies out into the world, we would expect the same structural relation to exist among human beings vis-a-vis their bodies. And in fact that is precisely what Gregory argues concerning the human nous (a word that is traditionally translated “mind” but which by the fourth century CE had submerged its intellectual connotations into the religious idea of its separateness from the physical world). In fact, so central is the nature-energies distinction to his conception of human personhood, that Gregory, again taking his inspiration from Philo (Creation of the World 46.134 – 46.135), uses it to explain the two accounts of the creation of human beings in Genesis 1 and 2 respectively. The original creation, in which God makes the human race “in our image, after our likeness” (Gen. 1:26) is of the transcendent human nature. The second creation, in which God “formed man of dust from the ground, and breathed into his nostrils the breath of life,” (Gen. 2:7) is of the energies of the soul coupled with the body in which they are present (Making of Man 16 – 17 [177 – 189], 22 [204 – 205]; Soul and Resurrection [157 – 160]).

The most important characteristic of the nature of the nous is that it provides for the unity of consciousness. How are my varied perceptions, deriving from various sense organs, all coordinated with each other? Aristotle himself had addressed this problem by postulating the existence of a common sense (On the Soul III 1 – 2). But Gregory moves beyond Aristotle’s psychological explanation. Using the metaphor of a city in which family members come in by various gates but all meet somewhere inside, Gregory’s answer is that this can occur only if we presuppose a transcendent self to which all of one’s experiences are referred (Making of Man 10 [152 – 153]). But this unity of consciousness is entirely mysterious and so is much like the mysterious nature of the Godhead (Making of Man 11 [153 – 156]). One is reminded of Kant’s theory of the transcendental unity of apperception (Critique of Pure Reason, Transcendental Deduction).

Yet the nous is also extended throughout the body by its energies, which constitute our ordinary psychological experiences (Making of Man 15 [176 – 177]; Soul and Resurrection [41 – 44]). Furthermore, the nous may at different times be more or less present to the body. During waking life the energies of the nous are present throughout the body. But during sleep the presence of nous to body is much more tenuous, and at death is even more so (though not absolutely nonexistent) (Great Catechism 8 [33]; Making of Man 12 – 15 [160 – 177]; Soul and Resurrection [45 – 48]).

The parallels between the divine and the human extend all the way down to the evidential basis for the existence of the human nous. For the existence of the nous rests on a “design” argument analogous to the argument for the energies of God. Indeed the body resembles a machine; and because the latter is governed by nous, it is probable that the former is also. And just as Gregory bases his indirect argument for the existence of God’s energies on the unexpected order of natural phenomena, so here he argues that because the components of a living body are observed to behave in a manner “contrary to [their] nature”–air being harnessed to produce sound, water impelled to move upward, and so forth–we may infer the existence of a nous imposing its will upon recalcitrant matter through its energies (Soul and Resurrection [33 – 40]). This should not be particularly surprising since Gregory regards the human body as a miniature, harmonious version of the cosmos as a whole (Inscriptions of the Psalms I 3 [441 – 444]).

There are two further characteristics of the human nous according to Gregory. First, because the human nous is created in the image of God, it possesses a certain “dignity of royalty” (to tes basileias axioma) that is lacking in the rest of creation. For it means that there is an aspect of the human person that is not of this world. Of no other organism can that be said. The souls of other species are totally immanent in their bodies. They have only energies, in other words. Only the human nous has a transcendent nature in addition to its energies. But that more than anything else is what makes us like God. Now God is of supreme worth. Consequently human beings have an inherent “dignity of royalty” just by virtue of being human (Making of Man 2 – 4 [132 – 136]).

Second, the nous is free. In an early work Gregory argues strenuously against astral determinism (On Fate [145 – 173]). In his more mature reflections, Gregory derives the freedom of the nous from the freedom of God. For God, being dependent on nothing, governs the universe through the free exercise of will; and the nous is created in God’s image (Making of Man 4 [136]). Once again, absent the theological emphasis, on both counts there is a broad similarity with Kant (cf. Groundwork II – III); and that similarity will only become more obvious when the ways in which Gregory applies these ideas are explored within the context of his philosophy of history.

5. History

Early on, Christian theology developed a distinctive way of conceptualizing God. Rather than a simple monotheism, Christianity held that God, though unitary, could be understood as also existing as a Trinity of three Persons–a Father, the font of the Godhead; a Son, the Word (John 1:1-5) and Wisdom (Prov. 8:22-31) of God, incarnated as Jesus Christ; and a Holy Spirit, who is sent into the world by the Father. Now Gregory lived at a crossroads in the theological understanding of this doctrine. Prior to the era of the ecumenical councils, the first of which was Nicaea, discussed above, the Trinity tended to be viewed as three stages in the outflow of God into the world, with the Father as its source and the Holy Spirit as its termination. Yet beginning with the Church councils, the Trinity gradually came to be understood differently, as three distinctions to be made within God’s inner nature itself. Not surprisingly, both models of the Trinity can be found in Gregory. Yet the first is clearly more congenial to his distinctive nature-energies understanding of God than the second. Indeed, one might question whether the second makes any sense at all in light of the typical Byzantine insistence on the incomprehensibility of God’s inner nature: if God’s nature is incomprehensible, how can we say it is both three and one–unless by doing so we wish to emphasize God’s very incomprehensibility?

Not only is the earlier model of the Trinity more consistent with Gregory’s view of God as a transcendent nature whose energies are projected into the world; it also adds to it a dynamic and historical dimension that the bare nature-energies distinction fails to capture on its own. As noted above, the Father is always transcendent; and at the other extreme, the Holy Spirit is God’s glory (Song of Songs VI [1117]): it “manifests [the Son’s] energy” (Great Catechism 2 [17]) in the world. It is the second Person of the Trinity who is the most interesting because it provides Gregory with the conceptual apparatus to explain God’s operation in history, for the point at which the second Person enters the world becomes the point in time in which God is more intimately present to the world than before.

Gregory’s philosophy of history begins with the fall of Adam from perfection. Earlier it was noted that according to Gregory humankind was fashioned in two creations–one of the nature of the nous, the other of its energies together with the body. The reason for the second creation was that God foresaw that humans would sin and so be unable to reproduce in a disembodied, angelic way; thus, they required bodies to allow them to propagate (Making of Man 16 – 17 [177 – 189], 22 [204 – 205]; Soul and Resurrection [157 – 160]). But the provision of bodies brings in its wake the tragic reality of death and sin, the overcoming of which was the purpose of the incarnation of Christ (Great Catechism 8 [33]).

Gregory’s Christology is the story of the entry of the second Person of the Trinity into the world. In Gregory’s words,

For although this last form of God’s presence amongst us is not the same as that former presence, still his existence amongst us equally both then and now is evidenced: now he rules in us in order to hold together that nature in being; then he was transfused in our nature, in order that our nature might by this transfusion of the divine become itself divine–being rescued from death and put beyond the reach of the tyranny of the Adversary. For his return from death becomes to our mortal race the commencement of our return to immortal life. (Great Catechism 25 [65 – 68])

In saying that initially Christ entered “our nature,” Gregory is echoing the typical Eastern Christian understanding of Christ’s saving work; for according to that tradition, Christ healed the effects of the fall of humankind in the same way as he healed the sick in his earthly ministry–simply by touching. Moreover, because, as Gregory of Nazianzus put it, “what was not assumed was not healed” (Letters 101.5), Christ had to touch all aspects of human existence from birth to death (Great Catechism 27 [69 – 72], 32 [77 – 80]). Thus the former had to wait until the disease of human sinfulness had fully manifested itself (Great Catechism 29 [73 – 76]). And by submitting to the latter, Christ offered himself in bondage to Satan in exchange for the whole of humanity, whom Satan then had under his tyranny (Great Catechism 22 – 24 [60 – 65]). Precisely how, in Christ, the divine thus entered into human nature we can never know–any more than we can understand the presence of our own souls to our bodies (Great Catechism 11 [44]).But after the resurrection of Christ, the second Person of the Trinity is no longer just “transfused in our nature,” but now “rules in us.” In other words, the second Person is now immanent in the world in the institution of the Church; for “he who sees the Church sees Christ” (Song of Songs XIII [1048]). Indeed, Gregory deploys, once again, his characteristic insistence on the unexpected unity of opposites, this time in the Church’s sacraments–life through death, justification through sin, blessing through curse, glory through disgrace, strength through weakness, and so forth–to argue for Christ’s continued, miraculous presence in his Church (Song of Songs VIII [948 – 949], XIII [1045 – 1052]). For this reason, Gregory subscribes to a realist theory of the sacraments. As baptism is to the soul, so the Eucharist is to the body (Great Catechism 37 [93]). In the former case, the presence of Christ “transforms what is born with a corruptible nature into a state of incorruption” (Great Catechism 33 [84], cf. 34 [85]). In the latter, Christ “disseminates himself in every believer through that flesh, whose substance comes from bread and wine, blending himself with the bodies of believers, to secure that, by this union with the immortal, man, too, may be a sharer in incorruption”–a process Gregory calls metastoicheiosis, “transelementation” (Great Catechism 37 [97]).

In the Resurrection, Christ “knitted together [the soul and body of humankind] . . . in a union never to be broken” (Great Catechism 16 [52], cf. 35 [89]) and “recalled [our] diseased nature by repentance to the grace of its original state” (Great Catechism 8 [37]). This is difficult to understand unless one notes that Gregory describes Christ’s saving work in the language of the Platonic forms (Great Catechism 16 [52], 32 [80 – 81]), which were classically construed as the originals of which the things that participate in them are mere images. Thus the resurrection and deification of Christ’s human nature are the prototypes of those to follow. The key idea here seems to be, once again, that human beings were created in God’s image. Formerly, that image was seen in the structural relation between the nature and energies of the human nous; now it is projected onto the axis of history.

Participation in Christ’s resurrection guarantees the resurrection of the body on the part of humanity. How does this happen? For one thing, as was noted earlier, Gregory holds that the nous is never completely separated from the body anyway, so in a sense there is no paradox in its revivification, But aren’t the bodily components scattered to the four winds after the decay of the corpse in the grave? How can they ever be reassembled? Gregory indeed addresses this problem and argues, strangely, that each particle of the body is stamped with one’s personal identity, and so it will be possible for the nous to eventually recognize and reassemble them all (Making of Man 26 – 27 [224 – 229], Soul and Resurrection [73 – 80]).

Similarly, the logical consequence of Christ’s deification is the apokatastasis–the restoration of humanity to its unfallen state. Because evil is a privation of the good and is therefore limited, Gregory believes that there is a limit to human degradation. At some point, everyone must turn around and strive for the good. Besides, the ultimate good, which is God, is infinitely attractive. Thus, Gregory endorses Origen’s (First Principles I 6.3, II 10.4 – 10.8, III 6.5 – 6.6) much-maligned theories of remedial punishment and universal salvation (Great Catechism 8 [36 – 37], 26 [69], 35 [92]; Making of Man 21 – 22 [201 – 205]; Soul and Resurrection [97 – 105, 152, 157 – 160]). In other words, for Gregory as for his intellectual ancestor Origen, everyone–even Satan himself (Great Catechism 26 [68 – 69])–will eventually be saved. This means that there is no such thing as eternal damnation. Hell is really purgatory; punishment is temporary and remedial. As Gregory puts it in a colorful metaphor, the process of purgation is like drawing a rope encrusted with dried mud through a small aperture: it’s hard on the rope, but it does come out clean on the other side (Soul and Resurrection [100]).

The final component of Gregory’s eschatology is his famous theory of perfection, which is derived from his conviction, which he inherits from Plato (Theaetetus 176b1 – 2) through Origen (First Principles III 6.1), that the purpose of human life is to achieve nothing less than likeness to God (homoiosis theoi). But there would seem to be a problem here: if God’s very essence is incomprehensible, how can we know what God is really like? The answer lies in the life of Christ, whose purpose was to demonstrate what God is like–an idea Gregory also borrows from Origen (First Principles I 2.8). Consequently, it is sufficient if we use Christ’s life as a model for our own (On Perfection [264 – 265, 269]). Nevertheless, it remains that God’s nature is infinitely removed from ours. But that doesn’t mean that striving to become like God is pointless; it only means that the process of perfection is unending (Against Eunomius I 15 [301], 22 [340], II [940 – 941], III 6.5 [707]; Great Catechism 21 [57 – 60]; Making of Man 21 [201 – 204]; Soul and Resurrection [96 – 97, 105]; On Perfection [285]). This idea forms the core of Gregory’s epistemology and ethics, which will be summarized below.

6. Knowledge

Gregory’s epistemological views are nicely brought out in his reflections on the life of Moses. The central feature of Gregory’s very sensitive analysis is the sequence of three theophanies that punctuate Moses’ life (Song of Songs XII [1025 – 1028]). Moses is pictured as one who has a thirst for utter intimacy with God, and the three theophanies are stages on his journey to that intimacy. The first theophany is the burning bush (Life of Moses II 1 – 116 [297 – 360]). In a traditional vein, Gregory takes light to be a symbol of knowledge. So the first stage of Moses’ progress is the acquisition of purely intellectual knowledge of God. This procedure is clearly rational; and Gregory will be found in what follows applying that quintessentially rational criterion–consistency–to the acquisition of religious truth.

To do this, Gregory recognizes, one must resort to philosophy as a source of conceptual tools. But philosophy in his day was almost wholly associated with paganism. So Gregory’s attitude toward philosophy is somewhat ambiguous. At one time he portrays philosophy, like Moses’ stepmother, as barren (Life of Moses II 10 – 12 [329]), and, like the Egyptian whom Moses killed, as something to be striven against (Life of Moses 13 – 18 [329 – 332]). Later, he recites with approval the common Christian interpretation of the Israelites’ spoiling of the Egyptians as a lesson to Christians on the importance of appropriating pagan wisdom in explaining Christian doctrine (Life of Moses II 115 [360]). But Gregory’s true position seems to lie between these two extremes: philosophy is useful if properly “circumcised,” that is, culled of any “foreskin” alien to the spirit of Christianity (Life of Moses II 39 – 40 [337]).

Of the same ilk is Gregory’s hermeneutical principle of distinguishing between the literal narrative (historia) of a Biblical passage and the spiritual contemplation (theoria) of it. In the tradition of Philo (Creation of the World 1.1 – 2.12) and Origen (First Principles I Pref., IV 1.1 – 3.5), he produces several arguments in favor of the allegorization of Scripture: (1) it is practiced by Christ, (2) it is recommended by Paul, (3) it makes passages edifying that would otherwise be immoral, and (4) it makes sense of passages that would otherwise be unintelligible or impossible (Song of Songs Preface [756 – 764]). This procedure is obviously predicated on the imperative of integrating Scripture into the entire matrix of worldly knowledge. Gregory never doubts that this matrix should be internally consistent; and he unselfconsciously employs the rule that of two claims that are mutually inconsistent, the more trumps the less edifying.

Up to this point intellectual development is characterized by the rigorous application of the rational criterion of consistency. But for Gregory the next two theophanies go far beyond the veneer of wisdom that mere logical consistency provides. The second theophany occurs atop Mount Sinai (Life of Moses II 117 – 201 [360 – 392]), and here we find not light but darkness. Thus the Israelites were first led through the desert by a cloudy pillar; and finally they arrived at the mountain of divine knowledge, which was wrapped in darkness. Thus when it comes to a more profound understanding of God, the relevant visual metaphor is darkness, not light. Similarly, the relevant auditory metaphor is silence, not speech (Ecclesiastes VII [732]). At this stage Moses learns a much deeper fact about God–that all the language we use of God is only superficial and that a truer understanding of God will only reveal God’s utter incomprehensibility. One who becomes aware of God’s complete mysteriousness has, paradoxically, learned more about God than the most articulate theologian.

At this stage there is no longer any reliance on the physical senses; indeed, as has been seen, at this level sight and hearing shut down. Instead, the vision of God is mediated by the so-called “spiritual senses,” an idea Gregory’s inherits from his theological mentor Origen (Song of Songs I 4, II 9 – 11, III 5). God cannot be perceived with the external senses, but some sort of mystical awareness of God is achievable internally. In this vein it is significant that, when discussing the spiritual senses, Gregory most often appeals, not to the “higher” senses of sight and hearing, but to the more intimate senses of smell, taste, and touch as metaphors by which to describe them (cf. Song of Songs I [780 – 784], III [821 – 828], IV [844]).

The third and final theophany revolves around Moses’ vision of God’s glory from the cleft in a rock (Life of Moses II 202 – 321 [392 – 429]). Moses, as Gregory interprets him, is one of those who crave ever more intimate communion with God. Earlier he had requested to know God’s name; now he asks to behold God’s glory. So God directs Moses to the cleft of a rock and walks by, placing a hand over the cleft to obscure Moses’ sight; only after God has passed is the hand removed, but by now all Moses can see is God’s back. Thus Moses finally realizes that the longing for utter intimacy with God can never be satisfied–faith will never be transformed into understanding (cf. Against Eunomius II [941])–but nevertheless “what Moses yearned for is satisfied by the very things which leave his desire unsatisfied” (Life of Moses II 235 [404]). Because God is an infinite being, the desire to know God is an infinite process; but in Gregory’s eyes this really makes it much more satisfying than some static Beatific Vision. The process of becoming ever closer to God does not cease at physical death (which is, after all, just one among many passing events punctuating human existence), but continues forever.

When reflecting on Gregory’s theory of knowledge as developed in The Life of Moses, one is struck by his commitment to rationalism–this despite his ambivalence on the value of pagan wisdom. Scripture for him is merely the starting point of the intellectual quest; and, given his reliance on allegory as a tool of exegesis, even that is brought within the ambit of a rational worldview. However, for Gregory the quest does not end with reason; rather, because God is utterly mysterious and infinitely remote, the quest is capped by a mystical ascent that always approaches but never reaches its destination. This intellectual dynamic is paralleled by a moral one, which will be sketched in what follows.

7. Virtue

Gregory’s ethical thought explores the implications of the theme of the “dignity of royalty” of the human person, which, as has been seen, derives from the idea that humans, and humans alone, were created in the image of God. This is perhaps the most far-reaching theme of Christian ethics. For it means that because there is a part of the human person that is literally not of this world, human beings are possessed of an intrinsic worth which is unique in creation. This idea obviously imposes certain obligations on us in relation to both ourselves and others. To others we owe mercy (Beatitudes V [1252 – 1253]) and the Christian virtue of agape (Beatitudes VII [1284]). To ourselves we owe the effort to overcome the deficiencies in our likeness to God; for we are unable to contemplate God directly, and morally our free will has been compromised by the passions (pathe). Thus with respect to ourselves we must strive for intellectual and moral perfection (Beatitudes III [1225 – 1228], V [1253 – 1260).

Because he was committed to the idea that humans have a unique value that demands respect, Gregory was an early and vocal opponent of slavery and also of poverty. Against the former Gregory marshals three arguments (Ecclesiastes IV [665]): (1) Only God has the right to enslave humans, and God does not choose to do so; indeed, it was God who gave human beings their free wills. (2) How dare a person take that precious entity–the only part of the created order to have been made in God’s image–and enslave it! (3) As humans who were created in the divine image, all people are radically equal; therefore, it is hubristic for some to arrogate to themselves absolute authority over others. Against the latter, he appeals, once again, to the “dignity of royalty” theme–that poverty is inconsistent with the rulership bestowed on humankind at its creation (On Compassion for the Poor [477]). Both slavery and poverty sully the dignity of human beings by degrading them to a station below the purple to which they were rightfully born; and although we may congratulate ourselves on having outlawed slavery, it is important to remember that for Gregory poverty is no different.

Moral progress is defined by two phases. Initially we must pursue the Stoic ideal of apatheia (passionlessness; cf. Diogenes Laertius, Lives VII 117), but in moderation (Beatitudes II [1216]). However, Gregory makes it clear that this moderation is due only to the exigencies of life in the flesh. At some point we must go beyond being satisfied with moderation and strive for a life which, in its breadth, is one of complete, not partial, virtue (Beatitudes IV [1241]), and, in its depth, is a matter of continual, unceasing perfection (Beatitudes IV [1244 – 1245]). The former idea, the unity of the virtues, Gregory derives, once again, from the Stoics (cf. Diogenes Laertius, Lives VII 125); but the latter is entirely his own.

Again, Gregory distinguishes between the Old Law and the New Law, which is built on the Old but goes beyond it (Beatitudes VI [1273 – 1276]). The Old Law deals with externals–works. But the New Law deals, not with works, but with the psychological springs from which works originate. To perfect one’s outward behavior is one thing; to purify one’s own heart is quite another. Thus, for example, whereas the Old Law prohibited murder, the New Law forbids even anger; and whereas the Old Law prohibited adultery, the New Law forbids even lust. Combining this theme with the one discussed in the last paragraph, one must conclude that Gregory sees moral progress as moving from a state of finite, external virtue to one of infinite, internal progress.

Once again, the similarity to Kant is striking. Like Gregory, Kant distinguishes four kinds of duty–perfect and imperfect duties to ourselves and to others (Metaphysical Principles of Virtue Introduction). More importantly, he distinguishes between duties of right and duties of virtue (Metaphysical Principles of Right Introduction III, Metaphysical Principles of Virtue Introduction VII). And the differences between duties of right and of virtue are similar to the distinctions Gregory draws between moderation and infinite perfection and between the Old and the New Law. Duties of right tend to deal with externals and, as “thou shalt nots,” can be completely fulfilled. Duties of virtue, on the other hand, tend to deal with the will and, as “thou shalts,” can never be completely fulfilled. In fact, in his famous discussion of the postulate of immortality Kant argues that the process of moral perfection is limitless and that if “ought” implies “can” it must be possible for humans to engage in an unending pursuit of perfection (Critique of Practical Reason Dialectic IV; cf. Metaphysical Principles of Virtue I 22).

8. Conclusion

This paper has tried to make clear what a rich resource of ideas we have in Gregory of Nyssa. What is also of great historical interest is Gregory’s pivotal role in the development of Western consciousness. Gregory takes numerous ideas from the Judaeo-Christian, particularly Philonian-Origenist, tradition and from the pagan Middle Platonist and Neoplatonist schools, digests them into a very original synthesis and in expounding that synthesis develops ideas that anticipate later Byzantine thinkers such as the Pseudo-Dionysius and Gregory Palamas. Not only that, but several of Gregory’s most important theories bear some resemblance to modern thinkers such as John Locke and Immanuel Kant (though through what channels of transmission, if any, is unclear–perhaps John Scotus Eriugena (c. 810 – c. 877), who quotes him extensively, and the Cambridge Platonists of the seventeenth century). Given all that, and given Gregory’s relative absence from most standard treatments of Western thought, I think may be fair to say that Gregory of Nyssa is one of the most under-appreciated figures in Western intellectual history.

9. References and Further Reading

a. Greek Texts

Gregor von Nyssa: Aus einem Briefe an Xenodorus. In Analecta Patristica: Texte und Abhandlungen der Griechischen Patristik, edited by Franz Diekamp, pp. 13 – 15. Orientalia Christiana Analecta 177. Rome: Pontificium Institutum Orientalium Studiorum, 1938.
- This is the source for an important fragment discussing Gregory’s concept of “energies.”
Gregorii Nysseni Opera. Edited by Werner Jaeger, et al. Leiden: Brill, 1960 – 1998.
- This critical edition of Gregory’s works is rapidly replacing the much older Migne edition. However the edition has not yet been completed.
Patrologia Graeca, vols. 44 – 46. Edited by J. P. Migne. Paris: Migne, 1857 – 1866.
- In the above citations I have placed page references to the Migne edition (which is still the only complete edition of Gregory’s works) in brackets.

b. Translations

From Glory to Glory: Texts from Gregory of Nyssa’s Mystical Writings. Edited by Jean Danielou. Crestwood: St. Vladimir’s Seminary Press, 1997.Gregory of Nyssa: Homilies on Ecclesiastes. Translated by Stuart G. Hall and Rachel Moriarty. Proceedings of the Seventh International Colloquium on Gregory of Nyssa. Berlin: Walter de Gruyter, 1993.
Life of Moses. Translated by Abraham J. Malherbe and Everett Ferguson. Classics of Western Spirituality. New York: Paulist Press, 1978.
On the Inscriptions of the Psalms. Translated by Ronald E. Heine. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1995.
Saint Gregory of Nyssa: Ascetical Works. Translated by Virginia W. Callahan. The Fathers of the Church, vol. 58. Washington: Catholic University Press, 1967.
Saint Gregory of Nyssa: Commentary on the Song of Songs. Translated by Casimir McCambley. Archbishop Iakovos Library of Ecclesiastical and Historical Sources, no. 12. Brookline: Hellenic College Press, 1987.
Select Writings and Letters of Gregory, Bishop of Nyssa. Translated by William Moore and Henry A. Wilson. A Select Library of Nicene and Post-Nicene Fathers of the Christian Church, 2d series, vol. 5. Grand Rapids: Eerdmans, 1954. Note that Book II of Against Eunomius in this edition is now regarded as Book IV (usually referred to under various titles as a separate work), Books III – XII are now regarded as Sections 1 – 10 of Book III, and the “Answer to Eunomius’ Second Book” is now regarded as Book II.
St. Gregory of Nyssa: The Soul and the Resurrection. Translated by Catharine P. Roth. Crestwood: St. Vladimir’s Seminary Press, 1993.
The Lord’s Prayer, The Beatitudes. Translated by Hilda C. Graef. Ancient Christian Writers, vol. 18. New York: Newman Press, 1954.

c. Secondary Sources

Balas, David L. Metousia Theou: Man’s Participation in God’s Perfections according to Saint Gregory of Nyssa. Rome: Pontificium Institutum Sancti Anselmi, 1966.Balthasar, Hans Urs von. Presence and Thought: An Essay on the Religious Philosophy of Gregory of Nyssa. San Francisco: Ignatius Press, 1995.
Barnes, Michel Rene. The Power of God: Dunamis in Gregory of Nyssa’s Trinitarian Theology. Washington: Catholic University Press, 2001.
Callahan, J. F. “Greek Philosophy and the Cappadocian Cosmology.” Dumbarton Oaks Papers 12 (1958): 30 – 57.
Cherniss, Harold Fredrik. The Platonism of Gregory of Nyssa. New York: Lenox Hill Publishers, 1971.
Coakley, Sarah, ed. Re-Thinking Gregory of Nyssa. Oxford: Blackwell Publishing, 2003.
Harrison, Verna E. F. Grace and Human Freedom According to St. Gregory of Nyssa. Lewiston: Edwin Mellen Press, 1992.
Heine, Ronald E. “Gregory of Nyssa’s Apology for Allegory.” Vigiliae Christianae 38 (1984): 360 – 370.
Jaeger, Werner. Two Rediscovered Works of Ancient Christian Literature: Gregory of Nyssa and Macarius. Leiden: E. J. Brill, 1954.
Keenan, Mary Emily. “De Professione Christiana and De Perfectione: A Study of the Ascetical Doctrine of Saint Gregory of Nyssa.” Dumbarton Oaks Papers 5 (1950): 167 – 207.
Ladner, Gerhart D. “The Philosophical Anthropology of Saint Gregory of Nyssa.” Dumbarton Oaks Papers 12 (1958): 59 – 94.
Lossky, Vladimir. The Vision of God. Crestwood: St. Vladimir’s Seminary Press, 1983.
Louth, Andrew. The Origins of the Christian Mystical Tradition: From Plato to Denys. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1981.
Meredith, Anthony. Gregory of Nyssa. London: Routledge, 1999.
Meredith, Anthony. The Cappadocians. Crestwood: St. Vladimir’s Seminary Press, 1995.
Moutsoulas, Elias D. The Incarnation of the Word and the Theosis of Man According to the Teaching of Gregory of Nyssa. Athens: Elias D. Moutsoulas, 2000.
Pelikan, Jaroslav. Christianity and Classical Culture: The Metamorphosis of Natural Theology in the Christian Encounter with Hellenism. New Haven: Yale University Press, 1993.
Otis, Brooks. “Cappadocian Thought as a Coherent System.” Dumbarton Oaks Papers 12 (1958): 96 – 124.
Stramara, Daniel F. “Gregory of Nyssa: An Ardent Abolitionist?” St. Vladimir’s Theological Quarterly. 41 (1997): 37 – 69.
Weiswurm, Alcuin A. The Nature of Human Knowledge According to Saint Gregory of Nyssa. Washington: Catholic University Press, 1952.

Author Information

Donald L. Ross
Email: dlr33@georgetown.edu
Georgetown University

U. S. A.

John Stuart Mill (1806—1873)

mill John Stuart Mill (1806-1873) profoundly influenced the shape of nineteenth century British thought and political discourse. His substantial corpus of works includes texts in logic, epistemology, economics, social and political philosophy, ethics, metaphysics, religion, and current affairs. Among his most well-known and significant are A System of Logic, Principles of Political Economy, On Liberty, Utilitarianism, The Subjection of Women, Three Essays on Religion, and his Autobiography.Mill’s education at the hands of his imposing father, James Mill, fostered both intellectual development (Greek at the age of three, Latin at eight) and a propensity towards reform. James Mill and Jeremy Bentham led the “Philosophic Radicals,” who advocated for rationalization of the law and legal institutions, universal male suffrage, the use of economic theory in political decision-making, and a politics oriented by human happiness rather than natural rights or conservatism. In his twenties, the younger Mill felt the influence of historicism, French social thought, and Romanticism, in the form of thinkers like Coleridge, the St. Simonians, Thomas Carlyle, Goethe, and Wordsworth. This led him to begin searching for a new philosophic radicalism that would be more sensitive to the limits on reform imposed by culture and history and would emphasize the cultivation of our humanity, including the cultivation of dispositions of feeling and imagination (something he thought had been lacking in his own education).

None of Mill’s major writings remain independent of his moral, political, and social agenda. Even the most abstract works, such as the System of Logic and his Examination of Sir William Hamilton’s Philosophy, serve polemical purposes in the fight against the German, or a priori, school otherwise called “intuitionism.” On Mill’s view, intuitionism needed to be defeated in the realms of logic, mathematics, and philosophy of mind if its pernicious effects in social and political discourse were to be mitigated.

In his writings, Mill argues for a number of controversial principles. He defends radical empiricism in logic and mathematics, suggesting that basic principles of logic and mathematics are generalizations from experience rather than known a priori. The principle of utility—that “actions are right in proportion as they tend to promote happiness; wrong as they tend to produce the reverse of happiness”—was the centerpiece of Mill’s ethical philosophy. On Liberty puts forward the “harm principle” that “the only purpose for which power can be rightfully exercised over any member of a civilized community, against his will, is to prevent harm to others.” In The Subjection of Women, he compares the legal status of women to the status of slaves and argues for equality in marriage and under the law.

This article provides an overview of Mill’s life and major works, focusing on his key arguments and their relevant historical contexts.

Biography
Works
Conclusion
References and Further Reading

1. Biography

Writing of John Stuart Mill a few days after Mill’s death, Henry Sidgwick claimed, “I should say that from about 1860-65 or thereabouts he ruled England in the region of thought as very few men ever did: I do not expect to see anything like it again.” (Collini 1991, 178). Mill established this rule over English thought through his writings in logic, epistemology, economics, social and political philosophy, ethics, metaphysics, religion, and current affairs. One can say with relative security, looking at the breadth and complexity of his work, that Mill was the greatest nineteenth century British philosopher.

This rule did not come about accidentally. It had been planned by his father James Mill from the younger Mill’s birth on May 20, 1806. The elder Mill was a towering figure for his eldest child, and Mill’s story must be told through his father’s. James Mill was born in Scotland in 1773 to a family of modest means. Through the patronage of Sir John and Lady Jane Stuart, he was able to attend the University of Edinburgh, which at the time was one of the finest universities in Europe. He trained for the Presbyterian ministry under the auspices of admired teachers like Dugald Stewart, who was an effective popularizer of Thomas Reid’s philosophy.

After a brief and generally unsuccessful stint as a minister, James Mill moved to London, where he began his career in letters. This was a difficult path for a man of very modest resources to take; he and his wife Harriet (married 1805) lived without financial security for well over a decade. It was only with the publication of his The History of British India in 1818—a work that took twelve years to write—that Mill was able to land a stable, well paying job at the East India Company that enabled him to support his large family (ultimately consisting of his wife and nine children).

Throughout the years of relative poverty, James Mill received assistance from friends including the great legal theorist and utilitarian reformer Jeremy Bentham, whom he met in 1808. The two men helped lead the movement of “Philosophic Radicals” that gave intellectual heft to the British Radical party of the early to mid-nineteenth century. Among their colleagues were David Ricardo, George Grote, Sir William Molesworth, John Austin, and Francis Place.

This philosophically inspired radicalism of the early nineteenth century positioned itself against the Whigs and Tories. The Radicals advocated for legal and political reform, universal male suffrage, the use of economic theory (especially Ricardo’s) in political decision-making, and a politics oriented by human happiness rather than by conservatism or by natural rights (which Bentham famously derided as “nonsense upon stilts”). Moreover, one aspect of their political temperament that distinguished them from Whigs and Tories was their rationalism—their willingness to recommend re-structuring social and political institutions under the explicit guidance of principles of reason (e.g. the principle of utility).

With Bentham’s financial support, the Radicals founded the Westminster Review (1824) to counter the Whig Edinburgh Review (1802) and the Tory Quarterly Review (1809). While Whig intellectuals and Radicals tended to align with each other on economic issues, both tending towards pro-urban, pro-industrial, laissez-faire policies, Tory intellectuals focused on defending traditional British social structures and ways of life associated with aristocratic agrarianism. These alliances can be seen in disputes over the Tory-supported Corn Laws, legislation meant to protect domestic agriculture by taxing imported grains.

Though Whigs and Radicals were often allied (eventually forming the Liberal party in the 1840s), some of the most acrimonious political and intellectual rows of the period were over their differences (for example, Macaulay’s famous public disputes with James Mill over political theorizing). James Mill saw the Whigs as too imbued with aristocratic interests to be a true organ of democratic reform. Only the Radicals could properly advocate for the middle and working classes. Moreover, unlike the Radicals, who possessed a systematic politics guided by the principle of utility (the principle that set the promotion of aggregate happiness as the standard for legislation and action), the Whigs lacked a systematic politics. The Whigs depended instead on a loose empiricism, which the senior Mill took as an invitation to complacency. Whigs, alternatively, took exception to the rationalistic tenor of the Radicals’ politics, seeing in it a dangerous psychological and historical naiveté. They also reacted to the extremity of the Radicals’ reformist temperaments, which revealed hostility to the Anglican church and to religion more generally.

The younger Mill was seen as the crown prince of the Philosophic Radical movement and his famous education reflected the hopes of his father and Bentham. Under the dominating gaze of his father, he was taught Greek beginning at age three and Latin at eight. He read histories, many of the Greek and Roman classics, and Newton by eleven. He studied logic and math, moving to political economy and legal philosophy in his early teens, and then went on to metaphysics. His training facilitated active command of the material through the requirement that he teach his younger siblings and through evening walks with his father when the precocious pupil would have to tell his father what he had learned that day. His year in France in 1820 led to a fluency in French and initiated his life-long interest in French thought and politics. As he matured, his father and Bentham both employed him as an editor. In addition, he founded a number of intellectual societies and study groups and began to contribute to periodicals, including the Westminster Review.

The stress of his education and of his youthful activity combined with other factors to lead to what he later termed, in his Autobiography, his “mental crisis” of 1826. There have been a wide variety of attempts to explain what led to this crisis—most of which center around his relation to his demanding father—but what matters most about the crisis is that it represents the beginning of Mill’s struggle to revise his father’s and Bentham’s thought, which he grew to think of as limited in a number of ways. Mill claims that he began to come out of his depression with the help of poetry (specifically Wordsworth). This contributed to his sense that while his education had fostered his analytic abilities, it had left his capacity for feeling underdeveloped. This realization made him re-think the attachment to the radical, rationalistic strands of Enlightenment thought that his education was meant to promote.

In response to this crisis, Mill began exploring Romanticism and a variety of other European intellectual movements that rejected secular, naturalistic, worldly conceptions of human nature. He also became interested in criticisms of urbanization and industrialization. These explorations were furthered by the writings of (and frequent correspondence with) thinkers from a wide sampling of intellectual traditions, including Thomas Carlyle, Auguste Comte, Alexis de Tocqueville, John Ruskin, M. Gustave d’Eichtal (and other St. Simonians), Herbert Spencer, Frederick Maurice, and John Sterling.

The attempt to rectify the perceived deficiencies of the Philosophic Radicals through engagement with other styles of thought began with Mill’s editing of a new journal, the London Review, founded by the two Mills and Charles Molesworth. Molesworth quickly bought out the old Westminster Review in 1834, to leave the new London and Westminster Review as the unopposed voice of the radicals. With James Mill’s death in 1836 and Bentham’s 1832 demise, Mill had more intellectual freedom. He used that freedom to forge a new “philosophic radicalism” that incorporated the insights of thinkers like Coleridge and Thomas Carlyle. (Collected Works [CW], I.209). One of his principal goals was “to shew that there was a Radical philosophy, better and more complete than Bentham’s, while recognizing and incorporating all of Bentham’s which is permanently valuable.” (CW, I.221).

This project is perhaps best indicated by Mill’s well-known essays of 1838 and 1840 on Bentham and Coleridge, which were published in the London and Westminster Review. Mill suggested that Bentham and Coleridge were “the two great seminal minds of England in their age” and used each essay to show their strengths and weaknesses, implying that a more complete philosophical position remained open for articulation. Mill would spend his career attempting to carry that out.

Harriet Taylor, friend, advisor, and eventual wife, helped him with this project. He met Taylor in 1830 and she was to join James Mill as one of the two most important people in Mill’s life. Unfortunately for Mill, Taylor was married. After two decades of an intense and somewhat scandalous platonic relationship, they were married in 1851 after her husband’s death. Her death in 1858 left him inconsolable.

There has been substantial debate about the nature and extent of Harriet Taylor’s influence on Mill. Beyond question is that Mill found in her a partner, friend, critic, and someone who encouraged him. Mill was probably most swayed by her in the realms of political, ethical, and social thought, but less so in the areas of logic and political economy (with the possible exception of his views on socialism).

Mill’s day-to-day existence was dominated by his work at the East India Company, though his job required little time, paid him well, and left him ample opportunity for writing. He began there in 1826, working under his father, and by his retirement in 1857, he held the same position as his father, chief examiner, which put him in charge of the memoranda guiding the company’s policies in India.

On his retirement and after the death of his wife, Mill was recruited to stand for a Parliamentary seat. Though he was not particularly effective during his one term as an MP, he participated in three dramatic events. (Capaldi 2004, 326-7). First, Mill attempted to amend the 1867 Reform Bill to substitute “person” for “man” so that the franchise would be extended to women. Though the effort failed, it generated momentum for women’s suffrage. Second, he headed the Jamaica Committee, which pushed (unsuccessfully) for the prosecution of Governor Eyre of Jamaica, who had imposed brutal martial law after an uprising by black farmers protesting poverty and disenfranchisement. Third, Mill used his influence with the leaders of the laboring classes to defuse a potentially dangerous confrontation between government troops and workers who were protesting the defeat of the 1866 Reform Bill.

After his term in Parliament ended and he was not re-elected, Mill began spending more time in France, writing, walking, and living with his wife’s daughter, Helen Taylor. It was to her that he uttered his last words in 1873, “You know that I have done my work.” He was buried next to his wife, Harriet.

Though Mill’s influence has waxed and waned since his death, his writings in ethics and social and political philosophy continue to be read most often. Many of his texts—particularly On Liberty, Utilitarianism, The Subjection of Women, and his Autobiography—continue to be reprinted and taught in universities throughout the world.

2. Works

Mill wrote on a startling number of topics. All his major texts, however, play a role in defending his new philosophic radicalism and the intellectual, moral, political, and social agendas associated with it.

a. A System of Logic

Though Mill’s biography reveals his openness to intellectual exploration, his most basic philosophical commitment—to naturalism—never seriously wavers. He is committed to the idea that our best methods of explaining the world are those employed by the natural sciences. Anything that we can know about human minds and wills comes from treating them as part of the causal order investigated by the sciences, rather than as special entities that lie outside it.

By taking the methods of the natural sciences as the only route to knowledge about the world, Mill sees himself as rejecting the “German, or a priori view of human knowledge,” (CW, I.233) or, as he also calls it, “intuitionism,” which was espoused in different ways by Kant, Reid, and their followers in Britain (e.g. Whewell and Hamilton). Though there are many differences among intuitionist thinkers, one “grand doctrine” that Mill suggests they all affirm is the view that “the constitution of the mind is the key to the constitution of external nature—that the laws of the human intellect have a necessary correspondence with the objective laws of the universe, such that these may be inferred from those.” (CW, XI.343). The intuitionist doctrine conceives of nature as being largely or wholly constituted by the mind rather than more or less imperfectly observed by it. One of the great dangers presented by this doctrine, from the perspective of Mill’s a posteriori school, is that it supports the belief that one can know universal truths about the world through evidence (including intuitions or Kantian categories of the understanding) provided by the mind alone rather than by nature. If the mind constitutes the world that we experience, then we can understand the world by understanding the mind. It was this freedom from appeal to nature and the lack of independent (i.e. empirical) checks to the knowledge claims associated with it that Mill found so disturbing.

For Mill, the problems with intuitionism extend far beyond the metaphysical and epistemological to the moral and political. As Mill says in his Autobiography when discussing his important treatise of 1843, A System of Logic:

The notion that truths external to the mind may be known by intuition or consciousness, independently of observation and experience, is, I am persuaded, in these times, the great intellectual support of false doctrines and bad institutions. By the aid of this theory, every inveterate belief and every intense feeling, of which the origin is not remembered, is enabled to dispense with the obligation of justifying itself by reason, and is erected into its own all-sufficient voucher and justification. There never was such an instrument devised for consecrating all deep-seated prejudices. And the chief strength of this false philosophy in morals, politics, and religion, lies in the appeal which it is accustomed to make to the evidence of mathematics and of the cognate branches of physical science. To expel it from these, is to drive it from its stronghold. (CW, I.233)

This charge against intuitionism, that it frees one from the obligation of justifying one’s beliefs, has strong roots in philosophic radicalism. We find Bentham, in his 1789 An Introduction to the Principles of Morals and Legislation, attacking non-utilitarian moral systems for just this reason: “They consist all of them in so many contrivances for avoiding the obligation of appealing to any external standard, and for prevailing upon the reader to accept of the author’s sentiment or opinion as a reason and that a sufficient one for itself.” (IPML, II.14). Mill thus saw his own commitment to the naturalism and empiricism of the “a posteriori school” of thought as part of a broader social and political agenda that advocated for reform and also undercut traditional foundations of conservatism.

Intuitionism, however, is often taken to be on much firmer ground than empiricism when it comes to accounting for our knowledge of mathematics and logic. This is especially true if one rejects the idea, found in people like Hobbes and Hume, that mathematical propositions like 2 + 3 = 5 are true merely because of the meaning of the constituents of the proposition, or, as Hume puts it, because of the proposition’s “relations of ideas.” Mill agrees with those (including Kant) who maintain that logical and mathematical truths are not merely linguistic—that they contain substantive, non-linguistic information. But this leaves Mill with the problem of accounting for the apparent necessity of such truths—a necessity which seems to rule out their origin in experience. To successfully attack intuitionism in “its stronghold,” the System of Logic needs to provide alternative grounds for basic principles of logic and mathematics (e.g. the principle of non-contradiction). In particular, Mill needs to show how “that peculiar character of what are called necessary truths” may be explained from experience and association alone.

The object of logic “is to ascertain how we come by that portion of our knowledge (much the greatest portion) which is not intuitive: and by what criterion we can, in matters not self-evident, distinguish between things proved and things not proved, between what is worthy and what is unworthy of belief.” (A System of Logic [System], I.i.1). It should be noted that logic goes beyond formal logic for Mill and into the conditions of truth more generally.

The text has the following basic structure. Book I addresses names and propositions. Books II and III examine deduction and induction, respectively. Book IV discusses a variety of operations of the mind, including observation, abstraction and naming, which are presupposed in all induction or instrumental to more complicated forms of induction. Book V reveals fallacies of reasoning. Finally, in Book VI, Mill treats the “moral sciences” and argues for the fundamental similarity of the methods of the natural and human sciences. In fact, the human sciences can be understood as themselves natural sciences with human objects of study.

i. Names, Propositions, and the Principles of Logic and Mathematics

Mill’s argument that the principles of mathematics and logic are justified by appeal to experience depends upon his distinction between verbal and real propositions, that is, between propositions that do not convey new information to the person who understands the meaning of the proposition’s terms and those propositions that do convey new information. The point of the distinction between verbal and real propositions is, first, to stress that all real propositions are a posteriori. Second, the distinction emphasizes that verbal propositions are empty of content; they tell us about language (i.e. what words mean) rather than about the world. In Kantian terms, Mill wants to deny the possibility of synthetic a priori propositions, while contending that we can still make sense of our knowledge of subjects like logic and mathematics.

This distinction between verbal and real propositions depends, in turn, upon Mill’s analysis of the meaning of propositions, i.e. how the meanings of constituents of propositions determine the meaning of the whole. A proposition, in which something is affirmed or denied of something, is formed by putting together two “names” or terms (subject and predicate) and a copula. The subject is the name “denoting the person or thing which something is affirmed or denied of.” (System, I.i.2). The predicate is “the name denoting that which is affirmed or denied.” The copula is “the sign denoting that there is an affirmation or denial,” which thereby enables “the hearer or reader to distinguish a proposition from any other kind of discourse.” In the proposition ‘gold is yellow’ for example, the copula ‘is’ shows that the quality yellow is being affirmed of the substance gold.

Mill divides names into general and singular names. All names, except proper names (e.g. Ringo, Buckley, etc) and names that signify an attribute only (e.g. whiteness, length), have a connotation and a denotation. That is, they both connote or imply some attribute(s) and denote or pick out individuals that fall under that description. The general name “man,” for example, denotes Socrates, Picasso, Plutarch and an indefinite number of other individuals, and it does so because they all share some attribute(s) (e.g. rational animal, featherless biped, etc.) connoted by man. The name “white” denotes all white things and implies or connotes the attribute whiteness. The word “whiteness,” by contrast, denotes or signifies an attribute but does not connote an attribute. Instead, it operates like a proper name in that its meaning derives entirely from what it denotes.

The meaning of a typical proposition is that the thing(s) denoted by the subject has the attribute(s) connoted by the predicate. In sentences like “Eleanor is tired” and “All men are mortal,” though the subjects pick out their objects differently (through a proper name and through an attribute, respectively), Mill’s basic story about the meaning of propositions holds.

Things become much more difficult with identity statements like “Hesperus is Phosphorus.” In this case, we have two proper names that pick out the same object (the planet Venus). Under Mill’s view, these proper names should have the same meaning because they denote the same object. But this appears untenable because the statement seems informative. It doesn’t seem plausible that the proposition merely states that an object is identical with itself, which would be the proposition’s meaning if Mill’s views on the meaning of proper names were correct. (See Frege and Russell’s attack on Mill’s account of the meaning of proper names; but see Kripke’s sophisticate defense of Mill on this in Naming and Necessity).

This discussion of the nature of names or terms enables us to understand Mill’s treatment of verbal and real propositions. Verbal propositions assert something about the meaning of names rather than about matters of fact. This means that, “(s)ince names and their signification are entirely arbitrary, such propositions are not, strictly speaking, susceptible of truth or falsity, but only of conformity or disconformity to usage or convention.” (System, I.vi.1). This kind of proposition simply “asserts of a thing under a particular name, only what is asserted of it in the fact of calling it by that name; and which, therefore, either gives no information, or gives it respecting the name, not the thing.” (I.vi.4). As such, verbal propositions are empty of content and they are the only things we know a priori, independently of checking the correspondence of the proposition to the world.

Real propositions, in contrast, “predicate of a thing some fact not involved in the signification of the name by which the proposition speaks of it; some attribute not connoted by that name.” (I.vi.4). Such propositions convey information that is not already included in the names or terms employed, and their truth or falsity depends on whether or not they correspond to relevant features of the world. Thus, “George is on the soccer team” predicates something of the subject George that is not included in its meaning (in this case, the denotation of the individual person) and its being true or not depends upon whether George is, in fact, on the team.

Mill’s great contention in the System of Logic is that logic and mathematics contain real, rather than merely verbal, propositions. He claims, for example, that the law of contradiction (i.e. the same proposition cannot at the same time be false and true) and the law of excluded middle (i.e. either a proposition is true or it is false) are both real propositions. They are, like the axioms of geometry, experimental truths, not truths known a priori. They represent generalizations or inductions from observation—very well-justified inductions, to be sure, but inductions nonetheless. This leads Mill to say that the necessity typically ascribed to the truths of mathematics and logic by his intuitionist opponents is an illusion, thereby undermining intuitionist argumentative fortifications at their strongest point.

A System of Logic thus represents the most thorough attempt to argue for empiricism in epistemology, logic, and mathematics before the twentieth century (for the best discussion of this point, see Skorupski 1989). Though revolutionary advances in logic and philosophy of language in the late nineteenth and early twentieth centuries have rendered many of Mill’s technical points about semantics and logic obsolete, the basic philosophical vision that Mill defends is very much a live option (see, for example, the work of Quine).

ii. Other Topics of Interest

There are some other topics covered in the System of Logic that are of interest. First is Mill’s treatment of deduction (in the form of the syllogism). His discussion is driven by one basic concern: Why wouldn’t a deduction simply tell us what we already know? How can it be informative? Mill discounts two common views about the syllogism, namely, that it is useless (because it tells us what we already know) and that it is the correct analysis of what the mind actually does when it discovers truths. To understand why Mill discounts these ways of thinking about deduction, we need to understand his views on inference.

The key point here is that all inference is from particular to particular. When we infer that the Duke of Wellington is mortal from “All men are mortal,” what we are really doing is inferring the Duke’s mortality from the mortality of the individual people with whose mortality we are familiar. What the mind does in making a deductive inference is not to move from a universal truth to a particular one. Rather, it moves from truths about a number of particulars to a smaller number (or one). The general statement that “All men are mortal” only allows us to more easily register what we know—it reflects neither the true inference being made nor the warrant or evidence we have for making the inference. Though general propositions are not necessary for reasoning, they are heuristically useful (as are the syllogisms that employ them). They aid us in memory and comprehension.

Mill’s famous treatment of induction reveals the a posteriori grounds for belief. He focuses on four different methods of experimental inquiry that attempt to single out from the circumstances that precede or follow a phenomenon the ones that are linked to the phenomenon by an invariable law. (System, III.viii.1). That is, we test to see if a purported causal connection exists by observing the relevant phenomena under an assortment of situations. If we wish, for example, to know whether a virus causes a disease, how can we prove it? What counts as good evidence for such a belief? The four methods of induction or experimental inquiry—the methods of agreement, of difference, of residues, and of concomitant variation—provide answers to these questions by showing what we need to demonstrate in order to claim that a causal law holds. Can we show, using the method of difference, that when the virus is not present the disease is also absent? If so, then we have some grounds for believing that the virus causes the disease.

Another issue addressed in A System of Logic that is of abiding interest is Mill’s handling of free will. Mill’s commitment to naturalism includes treating the human will as a potential object of scientific study: “Our will causes our bodily actions in the same sense, and in no other, in which cold causes ice, or a spark causes an explosion of gunpowder. The volition, a state of our mind, is the antecedent; the motion of our limbs in conformity to the volition, is the consequent.” (System, III.v.11). The questions that readily arise are how, under this view, can one take the will to be free and how can we preserve responsibility and feelings of choice?

In his Autobiography, Mill recounts his own youthful, melancholy acceptance of the doctrine of “Philosophical Necessity” (advocated by, among others, Robert Owen and his followers): “I felt as if I was scientifically proved to be the helpless slave of antecedent circumstances; as if my character and that of all others had been formed for us by agencies beyond our control, and was wholly out of our own power.” (CW, I.175-7). But it is precisely the idea that our character is formed for us, not by us, that Mill thinks is a “grand error.” (System, VI.ii.3). We have the power to alter our own character. Though our own character is formed by circumstances, among those circumstances are our own desires. We cannot directly will our characters to be one way rather than another, but we can will actions that shape those characters.

Mill addresses an obvious objection: what leads us to will to change our character? Isn’t that determined? Mill agrees. Our desire to change our character is determined largely by our experience of painful and pleasant consequences associated with our character. For Mill, however, the important point is that, even if we don’t control the desire to change our character, we are still left with the feeling of moral freedom, which is the feeling of being able to modify our own character “if we wish.” (System, VI.ii.3). What Mill wants to save in the doctrine of free will is simply the feeling that we have “real power over the formation of our own character.” (CW, I.177). If we have the desire to change our character, we find that we can. If we lack that desire it is “of no consequence what we think forms our character,” because we don’t care about altering it. For Mill, this is a thick enough notion of freedom to avoid fatalism.

One of the basic problems for this kind of naturalistic picture of human beings and wills is that it clashes with our first-person image of ourselves as reasoners and agents. As Kant understood, and as the later hermeneutic tradition emphasizes, we think of ourselves as autonomous followers of objectively given rules (Skorupski 1989, 279). It seems extremely difficult to provide a convincing naturalistic account of, for example, making a choice (without explaining away as illusory our first-person experience of making choices).

The desire to treat the will as an object, like ice or gunpowder, open to natural scientific study falls within Mill’s broader claim that the moral sciences, which include economics, history, and psychology among others, are fundamentally similar to the natural sciences. Though we may have difficulty running experiments in the human realm, that realm and its objects are, in principle, just as open to the causal explanations we find in physics or biology.

Perhaps the most interesting element of his analysis of the moral sciences is his commitment to what has been called “methodological individualism,” or the view that social and political phenomena are explicable by appeal to the behavior of individuals. In other words, social facts are reducible to facts about individuals: “The laws of the phenomena of society are, and can be, nothing but the laws of the actions and passions of human beings united together in the social state. Men, however, in a state of society, are still men; their actions and passions are obedient to the laws of individual human nature. Men are not, when brought together, converted into another kind of substance with different properties.” (System, VI.vii.1).

This position puts Mill in opposition to Auguste Comte, a founding figure in social theory (he coined the term “sociology”) and an important influence on, and correspondent with, Mill. Comte takes sociology rather than psychology to be the most basic of human sciences and takes individuals and their conduct to be best understood through the lens of social analysis. To put it simplistically, for Comte, the individual is an abstraction from the whole—its beliefs and conduct are determined by history and society. We understand the individual best, on this view, when we see the individual as an expression of its social institutions and setting. This naturally leads to a kind of historicism. Though Mill recognized the important influences of social institutions and history on individuals, for him society is nevertheless only able to shape individuals through affecting their experiences—experiences structured by universal principles of human psychology that operate in all times and places. (See Mandelbaum 1971, 167ff).

b. An Examination of Sir William Hamilton’s Philosophy

Mill’s attacks on intuitionism continued throughout his life. One notable example is his 1865 An Examination of Sir William Hamilton’s Philosophy, which revisits much of the same ground as A System of Logic in the guise of a thorough-going criticism of Hamilton, a thinker influenced by Reid and Kant whom Mill took as representing “the great fortress of the intuitional philosophy in this country.” (CW, I.270). The rather hefty volume explores “some of the disputed questions in the domain of psychology and metaphysics.” (CW, I.271).

Among the doctrines given most attention is that of the “relativity of knowledge,” something to which Mill takes Hamilton as insufficiently committed. It is the idea that we have no access to “things-in-themselves” (thus, the relativity versus absoluteness of knowledge) and that we are limited to analyzing the phenomena of consciousness. Mill, who accepts this basic principle, counts himself as a Berkeleian phenomenalist and famously defines matter in the Examination as “a Permanent Possibility of Sensation,” (CW, IX.183), thinks that Hamilton accepts this doctrine in a confused manner. “He affirms without reservation, that certain attributes (extension, figures, etc.) are known to us as they really exist out of ourselves; and also that all our knowledge of them is relative to us. And these two assertions are only reconcileable, if relativity to us is understood in the altogether trivial sense, that we know them only so far as our faculties permit.” (CW, IX.22). Hamilton therefore seems to want to have his cake and eat it too when it comes to knowledge of the external world. On the one hand, he wants to declare that we have access to things as they are, thereby aligning himself with Reid’s project of avoiding the fall into (Humean) skepticism—a fall prompted by the Lockean “way of ideas.” On the other hand, he wants to follow Kant in limiting our knowledge of things-in-themselves, thereby reigning in the pretensions of metaphysical speculation. Mill avoids this dilemma by rejecting Hamilton’s position that we know things outside as they really are.

One point of historical interest about the Examination is the impact that it had on the way that the history of philosophy is taught. Mill’s demolition of Hamilton’s reputation led to the removal of Reid and the school of Scottish “common sense” philosophy from the curriculum in Britain and America. As Kuklick puts it, the success of Mill’s Examination “is the crucial event in understanding the development of the contemporary view of Modern Philosophy in America.” By destroying “the credibility of the entire Scottish reply to Hume,” Mill’s Examination led Anglo-American philosophers to turn to Kant in the later part of the nineteenth century in order to find more satisfactory response to Humean skepticism (Kuklick 1984, 128). Thus, the standard course in Modern Philosophy that includes all or some of Descartes, Spinoza, Leibniz, Locke, Berkeley, Hume, and Kant, is partly an unintended consequence of the publication of Mill’s attack on Hamilton and on intuitionism more broadly.

c. Psychological Writings

As noted in the discussion of A System of Logic, Mill’s commitment to “methodological individualism” makes psychology the foundational moral science. Though he never wrote a work of his own on psychology, he edited and contributed notes to an 1869 re-issue of his father’s 1829 work in psychology, Analysis of the Phenomena of the Human Mind, and reviewed the work of his friend and correspondent, Alexander Bain. All three were proponents of the associationist school of psychology, whose roots go back to Hobbes and especially Locke and whose members included Gay, Hartley, and Priestly in the eighteenth century and the Mills, Bain, and Herbert Spencer in the nineteenth century.

Mill distinguishes between the a posteriori and a priori schools of psychology. The former “resolves the whole contents of the mind into experience.” (CW, XI.341). The latter emphasizes that “in every act of thought, down to the most elementary, there is an ingredient which is not given to the mind, but contributed by the mind in virtue of its inherent powers.” (CW, XI.344). In the a priori or intuitionist school, experience “instead of being the source and prototype of our ideas, is itself a product of the mind’s own forces working on the impressions we receive from without, and has always a mental as well as an external element.” (CW, XI.344).

The associationist version of a posteriori psychology has two basic doctrines: “first, that the more recondite phenomena of the mind are formed out of the more simple and elementary; and, secondly, that the mental law, by means of which this formation takes place, is the Law of Association.” (CW, XI.345). The associationist psychologists, then, would attempt to explain mental phenomena by showing them to be the ultimate product of simpler components of experience (e.g. color, sound, smell, pleasure, pain) connected to each other through associations. These associations take two basic forms: resemblance and contiguity in space and/or time. Thus, these psychologists attempt to explain our idea of an orange or our feelings of greed as the product of simpler ideas connected by association.

Part of the impulse for this account of psychology is its apparent scientific character and beauty. Associationism attempts to explain a large variety of mental phenomena on the basis of experience plus very few mental laws of association. It therefore appeals to those who are particularly drawn to simplicity in their scientific theories.

Another attraction of associationist psychology, however, is its implications for views on moral education and social reform. If the contents of our minds, including beliefs and moral feelings, are products of experiences that we undergo connected according to very simple laws, then this raises the possibility that human beings are capable of being radically re-shaped—that our natures, rather than being fixed, are open to major alteration. In other words, if our minds are cobbled together by laws of association working on the materials of experience, then this suggests that if our experiences were to change, so would our minds. This doctrine tends to place much greater emphasis on social and political institutions like the family, the workplace, and the state, than does the doctrine that the nature of the mind offers strong resistance to being shaped by experience (i.e. that the mind molds experience rather than being molded by it). Associationism thereby fits nicely into an agenda of reform, because it suggests that many of the problems of individuals are explained by their situations (and the associations that these situations promote) rather than by some intrinsic feature of the mind. As Mill puts it in the Autobiography in discussing the conflict between the intuitionist and a posteriori schools:

The practical reformer has continually to demand that changes be made in things which are supported by powerful and widely spread feelings, or to question the apparent necessity and indefeasibleness of established facts; and it is often an indispensable part of his argument to shew, how these powerful feelings had their origin, and how those facts came to seem necessary and indefeasible. There is therefore a natural hostility between him and a philosophy which discourages the explanation of feelings and moral facts by circumstances and association, and prefers to treat them as ultimate elements of human nature…I have long felt that the prevailing tendency to regard all the marked distinctions of human character as innate, and in the main indelible, and to ignore the irresistible proofs that by far the greater part of those differences, whether between individuals, races, or sexes, are such as not only might but naturally would be produced by differences in circumstances, is one of the chief hindrances to the rational treatment of great social questions, and one of the greatest stumbling blocks to human improvement. (CW, I.269-70).

d. Utilitarianism

Another maneuver in his battle with intuitionism came when Mill published Utilitarianism (1861) in installments in Fraser’s Magazine (it was later brought out in book form in 1863). It offers a candidate for a first principle of morality, a principle that provides us with a criterion distinguishing right and wrong. The utilitarian candidate is the principle of utility, which holds that “actions are right in proportion as they tend to promote happiness; wrong as they tend to produce the reverse of happiness. By happiness is intended pleasure and the absence of pain; by unhappiness, pain and the privation of pleasure.” (CW, X.210).

i. History of the Principle of Utility

By Mill’s time, the principle of utility possessed a long history stretching back to the 1730’s (with roots going further back to Hobbes, Locke, and even to Epicurus). In the eighteenth and early nineteenth centuries, it had been explicitly invoked by three British intellectual factions. Though all may have agreed that an action’s consequences for the general happiness were to dictate its rightness or wrongness, the reasons behind the acceptance of that principle and the uses to which the principle was put varied greatly.

The earliest supporters of the principle of utility were the religious utilitarians represented by, among others, John Gay, John Brown, Soame Jenyns, and, most famously, William Paley, whose 1785 The Principles of Moral and Political Philosophy was one of the most frequently re-printed and well read books of moral thought of the late eighteenth and early nineteenth centuries (to Mill’s dismay, Bentham’s utilitarianism was often conflated with Paley’s). Religious utilitarianism was very popular among the educated classes and dominated in the universities until the 1830’s. These thinkers were all deeply influenced by Locke’s empiricism and psychological hedonism and often stood opposed to the competing moral doctrines of Shaftesbury, Hutcheson, Clarke, and Wollaston.

The religious utilitarians looked to the Christian God to address a basic problem, namely how to harmonize the interests of individuals, who are motivated by their own happiness, with the interests of the society as a whole. Once we understand that what we must do is what God wills (because of God’s power of eternal sanction) and that God wills the happiness of his creatures, morality and our own self-interest will be seen to overlap. God guarantees that an individual’s self-interest lies in virtue, in furthering the happiness of others. Without God and his sanctions of eternal punishment and reward, it would be hard to find motives that “are likely to be found sufficient to withhold men from the gratification of lust, revenge, envy, ambition, avarice.” (Paley 2002 [1785], 39). As we shall see in a moment, another possible motivation for caring about the general happiness—this one non-religious—is canvassed by Mill in Chapter Three of Utilitarianism.

In contrast to religious utilitarianism, which had few aspirations to be a moral theory that revises ordinary moral attitudes, the two late-eighteenth century secular versions of utilitarianism grew out of various movements for reform. The principle of utility—and the correlated commitments to happiness as the only intrinsically desirable end and to the moral equivalency of the happiness of different individuals—was itself taken to be an instrument of reform.

One version of secular utilitarianism was represented by William Godwin (husband of Mary Wollstonecraft and father of Mary Shelley), who achieved great notoriety with the publication of his Political Justice of 1793. Though his fame (or infamy) was relatively short-lived, Godwin’s use of the principle of utility for the cause of radical political and social critique began the identification of utilitarianism with anti-religiosity and with dangerous democratic values.

The second version of secular utilitarianism, and the one that inspired Mill, arose from the work of Jeremy Bentham. Bentham, who was much more successful than Godwin at building a movement around his ideas, employed the principle of utility as a device of political, social, and legal criticism. It is important to note, however, that Bentham’s interest in the principle of utility did not arise from concern about ethical theory as much as from concern about legislative and legal reform.

This history enables us to understand Mill’s invocation of the principle of utility in its polemical context—Mill’s support of that principle should not be taken as mere intellectual exercise. In the realm of politics, the principle of utility served to bludgeon opponents of reform. First and foremost, reform meant extension of the vote. But it also meant legal reform, including overhaul of the common law system and of legal institutions, and varieties of social reform, especially of institutions that tended to favor aristocratic and moneyed interests. Though Bentham and Godwin intended it to have this function in the late eighteenth century, utilitarianism became influential only when tied with the political machinery of the Radical party, which had particular prominence on the English scene in the 1830’s.

In the realm of ethical debate, Mill took his opponents to be the “intuitionists” led by Sedgwick and Whewell, both Cambridge men. They were the contemporary representatives of an ethical tradition that understood its history as tied to Butler, Reid, Coleridge, and turn of the century German thought (especially that of Kant). Though intuitionists and members of Mill’s a posteriori or “inductive” school recognize “to a great extent, the same moral laws,” they differ “as to their evidence and the source from which they derive their authority. According to the one opinion, the principles of morals are evident a priori, requiring nothing to command assent except that the meaning of the terms be understood. According to the other doctrine, right and wrong, as well as truth and falsehood, are questions of observation and experience.” (CW, X.206).

The chief danger represented by the proponents of intuitionism was not from the ethical content of their theories per se, which defended honesty, justice, benevolence, etc., but from the kinds of justifications offered for their precepts and the support such a view lent to the social and political status quo. As we saw in the discussion of the System of Logic and with reference to Mill’s statements in his Autobiography, he takes intuitionism to be dangerous because it allegedly enables people to ratify their own prejudices as moral principles—in intuitionism, there is no “external standard” by which to adjudicate differing moral claims (for example, Mill understood Kant’s categorical imperative as getting any moral force it possesses either from considerations of utility or from mere prejudice hidden by hand-waving). The principle of utility, alternatively, evaluates moral claims by appealing to the external standard of pain and pleasure. It presented each individual for moral consideration as someone capable of suffering and enjoyment.

ii. Basic Argument

Mill’s defense of the principle of utility in Utilitarianism includes five chapters. In the first, Mill sets out the problem, distinguishes between the intuitionist and “inductive” schools of morality, and also suggests limits to what we can expect from proofs of first principles of morality. He argues that “(q)uestions of ultimate ends are not amenable to direct proof.” (CW, X.207). All that can be done is to present considerations “capable of determining the intellect either to give or withhold its assent to the doctrine; and this is equivalent to proof.” (CW, X.208). Ultimately, he will want to prove in Chapter Four the basis for the principle of utility—that happiness is the only intrinsically desirable thing—by showing that we spontaneously accept it on reflection. (Skorupski 1989, 8). It is rather easy to show that happiness is something we desire intrinsically, not for the sake of other things. What is hard is to show that it is the only thing we intrinsically desire or value. Mill agrees that we do not always value things like virtue as means or instruments to happiness. We do sometimes seem to value such things for their own sakes. Mill contends, however, that on reflection we will see that when we appear to value them for their own sakes we are actually valuing them as parts of happiness (rather than as intrinsically desirable on their own or as means to happiness). That is, we value virtue, freedom, etc. as things that make us happy by their mere possession. This is all the proof we can give that happiness is our only ultimate end; it must rely on introspection and on careful and honest examination of our feelings and motives.

In Chapter Two, Mill corrects misconceptions about the principle of utility. One misconception is that utilitarianism, by endorsing the Epicurean view “that life has…no higher end than pleasure” is a “doctrine worthy only of swine.” (CW, X.210). Mill counters that “the accusation supposes human beings to be capable of no pleasures except those of which swine are capable.” (CW, X.210). He proffers a distinction (one not found in Bentham) between higher and lower pleasures, with higher pleasures including mental, aesthetic, and moral pleasures. When we are evaluating whether or not an action is good by evaluating the happiness that we can expect to be produced by it, he argues that higher pleasures should be taken to be in kind (rather than by degree) preferable to lower pleasures. This has led scholars to wonder whether Mill’s utilitarianism differs significantly from Bentham’s and whether Mill’s distinction between higher and lower pleasures creates problems for our ability to know what will maximize aggregate happiness.

A second objection to the principle of utility is that “it is exacting too much to require that people shall always act from the inducement of promoting the general interest of society.” (CW, X.219). Mill replies that this is to “confound the rule of action with the motive of it.” (CW, X.219). Ethics is supposed to tell us what our duties are, “but no system of ethics requires that the sole motive of all we do shall be a feeling of duty; on the contrary, ninety-nine hundredths of all our actions are done from other motives, and rightly so done if the rule of duty does not condemn them.” (CW, X.219). To do the right thing, in other words, we do not need to be constantly motivated by concern for the general happiness. The large majority of actions intend the good of individuals (including ourselves) rather than the good of the world. Yet the world’s good is made up of the good of the individuals that constitute it and unless we are in the position of, say, a legislator, we act properly by looking to private rather than to public good. Our attention to the public well-being usually needs to extend only so far as is required to know that we aren’t violating the rights of others.

Chapter Three addresses the topic of motivation again by focusing on the following question: What is the source of our obligation to the principle of utility? What, in other words, motivates us to act in ways approved of by the principle of utility? With any moral theory, one must remember that ‘ought implies can,’ i.e. that if moral demands are to be legitimate, we must be the kind of beings that can meet those demands. Mill defends the possibility of a strong utilitarian conscience (i.e. a strong feeling of obligation to the general happiness) by showing how such a feeling can develop out of the natural desire we have to be in unity with fellow creatures—a desire that enables us to care what happens to them and to perceive our own interests as linked with theirs. Though Chapter Two showed that we do not need to attend constantly to the general happiness, it is nevertheless a sign of moral progress when the happiness of others, including the happiness of those we don’t know, becomes important to us.

Finally, Chapter Five shows how utilitarianism accounts for justice. In particular, Mill shows how utilitarianism can explain the special status we seem to grant to justice and to the violations of it. Justice is something we are especially keen to defend. Mill begins by marking off morality (the realm of duties) from expediency and worthiness by arguing that duties are those things we think people ought to be punished for not fulfilling. He then suggests that justice is demarcated from other areas of morality, because it includes those duties to which others have correlative rights, “Justice implies something which it is not only right to do, and wrong not to do, but which some individual person can claim from us as his moral right.” (CW, X.247). Though no one has a right to my charity, even if I have a duty to be charitable, others have rights not to have me injure them or to have me repay what I have promised.

Critics of utilitarianism have placed special emphasis on its inability to provide a satisfactory account of rights. For Mill, to have a right is “to have something which society ought to defend me in the possession of. If the objector goes on to ask why it ought, I can give no other reason than general utility.” (CW, X.250). But what if the general utility demands that we violate your rights? The intuition that something is wrong if your rights can be violated for the sake of the general good provoked the great challenge to utilitarian conceptions of justice, leveled with special force by twentieth century thinkers like John Rawls.

e. On Liberty

The topic of justice received further treatment at Mill’s hands in his famous 1859 book On Liberty. This work is the one, along with A System of Logic, that Mill thought would have the most longevity. It concerns civil and social liberty or, to look at it from the contrary point of view, the nature and limits of the power that can legitimately be exercised by society over the individual.

Mill begins by retelling the history of struggle between rulers and ruled and suggests that social rather than political tyranny is the greater danger for modern, commercial nations like Britain. This social “tyranny of the majority” (a phrase Mill takes from Tocqueville) arises from the enforcement of rules of conduct that are both arbitrary and strongly adhered to. The practical principle that guides the majority “to their opinions on the regulation of human conduct, is the feeling in each person’s mind that everybody should be required to act as he, and those with whom he sympathizes, would like them to act.” (On Liberty [OL], 48). Such a feeling is particularly dangerous because it is taken to be self-justifying and self-evident.

There is a need, therefore, for a rationally grounded principle which governs a society’s dealings with individuals. This “one very simple principle”—often called the “harm principle”—entails that:

[T]he sole end for which mankind are warranted, individually or collectively, in interfering with the liberty of action of any of their number, is self-protection. That the only purpose for which power can be rightfully exercised over any member of a civilized community, against his will, is to prevent harm to others. His own good, either physical or moral, is not a sufficient warrant. He cannot rightfully be compelled to do or forbear because it will be better for him to do so, because it will make him happier, because, in the opinion of others, to do so would be wise, or even right. These are good reasons for remonstrating with him, or reasoning with him, or persuading him, or entreating him, but not for compelling him, or visiting him with any evil in case he do otherwise. (OL, 51-2)

This anti-paternalistic principle identifies three basic regions of human liberty: the “inward domain of consciousness,” liberty of tastes and pursuits (i.e. of framing our own life plan), and the freedom to unite with others.

Mill, unlike other liberal theorists, makes no appeal to “abstract right” in order to justify the harm principle. The reason for accepting the freedom of individuals to act as they choose, so long as they cause minimal or no harm to others, is that it would promote “utility in the largest sense, grounded on the permanent interests of man as a progressive being.” (OL, 53). In other words, abiding by the harm principle is desirable because it promotes what Mill calls the “free development of individuality” or the development of our humanity.

Behind this rests the idea that humanity is capable of progress—that latent or underdeveloped abilities and virtues can be actualized under the right conditions. Human nature is not static. It is not merely re-expressed in generations and individuals. It is “not a machine to be built after a model, and set to do exactly the work prescribed for it, but a tree, which requires to grow and develop itself on all sides, according to the tendency of the inward forces which make it a living thing.” (OL, 105). Though human nature can be thought of as something living, it is also, like an English garden, something amenable to improvement through effort. “Among the works of man, which human life is rightly employed in perfecting and beautifying, the first in importance surely is man himself.” (OL, 105). The two conditions that promote development of our humanity are freedom and variety of situation, both of which the harm principle encourages.

A basic philosophical problem presented by the work is what counts as “harm to others.” Where should we mark the boundary between conduct that is principally self-regarding versus conduct that involves others? Does drug-use cause harm to others sufficient to be prevented? Does prostitution? Pornography? Should polygamy be allowed? How about public nudity? Though these are difficult questions, Mill provides the reader with a principled way of deliberating about them.

f. The Subjection of Women and Other Social and Political Writings

Many volumes of Mill’s writings deal with topics of social and political concern. These include writings on specific political problems in India, America, Ireland, France, and England, on the nature of democracy (Considerations on Representative Government) and civilization, on slavery, on law and jurisprudence, on the workplace, and on the family and the status of women. The last subject was the topic of Mill’s well-known The Subjection of Women, an important work in the history of feminism.

The radical nature of Mill’s call for women’s equality is often lost to us after over a century of protest and changing social attitudes. Yet the subordination of women to men when Mill was writing remains striking. Among other indicators of this subordination are the following: (1) British women had fewer grounds for divorce than men until 1923; (2) Husbands controlled their wives personal property (with the occasional exception of land) until the Married Women’s Property Acts of 1870 and 1882; (3) Children were the husband’s; (4) Rape was impossible within a marriage; and (5) Wives lacked crucial features of legal personhood, since the husband was taken as the representative of the family (thereby eliminating the need for women’s suffrage). This gives some indication of how disturbing and/or ridiculous the idea of a marriage between equals could appear to Victorians.

The object of the essay was to show “(t)hat the principle which regulates the existing social relations between the two sexes—the legal subordination of one sex to the other—is wrong in itself, and now one of the chief hindrances to human improvement; and that it ought to be replaced by a principle of perfect equality, admitting no power or privilege on the one side, nor disability on the other.” (CW, XXI.261). This shows how Mill appeals to both the patent injustice of contemporary familial arrangements and to the negative moral impact of those arrangements on the people within them. In particular, he discusses the ways in which the subordination of women negatively affects not only the women, but also the men and children in the family. This subordination stunts the moral and intellectual development of women by restricting their field of activities, pushing them either into self-sacrifice or into selfishness and pettiness. Men, alternatively, either become brutal through their relationships with women or turn away from projects of self-improvement to pursue the social “consideration” that women desire.

It is important to note that Mill’s concern for the status of women dovetails with the rest of his thought—it is not a disconnected issue. For example, his support for women’s equality was buttressed by associationism, which claims that minds are created by associative laws operating on experience. This implies that if we change the experiences and upbringing of women, then their minds will change. This enabled Mill to argue against those who tried to suggest that the subordination of women to men reflected a natural order that women were by nature incapable of equality with men. If many women were incapable of true friendship with noble men, says Mill, that is not a result of their natures, but of their faulty environments.

g. Principles of Political Economy

Another work that addresses issues of social and political concern is Mill’s Principles of Political Economy of 1848. The book went through numerous editions and served as the dominant British textbook in economics until being displaced by Alfred Marshall’s 1890 Principles of Economics. Mill intended the work as both a survey of contemporary economic thought (highlighting the theories of David Ricardo, but also including some contributions of his own on topics like international trade) and as an exploration of applications of economic ideas to social concerns. It was “not a book merely of abstract science, but also of application, and treated Political Economy not as a thing by itself, but as a fragment of a greater whole.” (CW, I.243). These two interests nicely divide the text into the first three more technical books on production, distribution, and exchange and the last two books, which address the influences of societal progress and of government on economic activity (and vice versa). The technical work is largely obsolete. Mill’s relating of economics and society, however, remains of great interest.

In particular, Mill shared concerns with others (e.g. Carlyle, Coleridge, Southey, etc.) about the moral impact of industrialization. Though many welcomed the material wealth produced by industrialization, there was a sense that those very cornerstones of British economic growth—the division of labor (including the increasing simplicity and repetitiveness of the work) and the growing size of factories and businesses—led to a spiritual and moral deadening.

Coleridge expressed this in his contrast of mere “civilization” with “cultivation”:

The permanency of the nation…and its progressiveness and personal freedom…depend on a continuing and progressive civilization. But civilization is itself but a mixed good, if not far more a corrupting influence, the hectic of disease, not the bloom of health, and a nation so distinguished more fitly to be called a varnished than a polished people, where this civilization is not grounded in cultivation, in the harmonious development of those qualities and faculties that characterize our humanity. We must be men in order to be citizens. (Coleridge 1839, 46).

“Civilization” expresses central features of modernization, including industrialism, cosmopolitanism, and increasing material wealth. But, for Coleridge, civilization needed to be subordinated to cultivation of our humanity (expressed in terms similar to those later found in On Liberty).

This concern for the moral impact of economic growth explains, among other things, his commitment to a brand of socialism. In an essay on the French historian Michelet, Mill praises the monastic associations of Italy and France after the reforms of St. Benedict: “Unlike the useless communities of contemplative ascetics in the East, they were diligent in tilling the earth and fabricating useful products; they knew and taught that temporal work may also be a spiritual exercise.” (CW, XX.240). It was the desire to transform temporal work into a spiritual and moral exercise that led Mill to favor socialist changes in the workplace.

In order to transform the workplace from a setting filled with antagonism into a “school of sympathy” that would enable workers to feel a part of something greater than themselves—thereby mitigating the rampant selfishness encouraged by industrial society—Mill recommends “industrial co-operatives.” Mill thought that these co-operatives had the advantage over communes or other socialist institutions because they were able to compete against traditional firms (his complaint against many other socialists is that they undervalued competition as a morally useful stimulus to activity). These co-operatives can take two forms: a profit-sharing system in which worker pay is tied to the success of the business or a worker co-operative in which workers share ownership of capital. The latter was preferable because it turned all the workers into entrepreneurs, calling upon many of the faculties that mere labor for pay left to atrophy.

Though Mill contended that laborers were generally unfit for socialism given their current level of education and development, he thought that modern industrial societies should take small steps towards fostering co-operatives. Included among these steps was the institution of limited partnerships. Up to Mill’s time, partners shared full liability for losses, including any personal property they owned—obviously a strong deterrent to the founding of worker co-operatives.

Mill’s recommendations for the economic organization of society, like his political and social policies, always paid careful attention to how institutions, laws, and practices impacted the intellectual, moral, and affective well-being of the individuals operating under or within them.

h. Essays on Religion

Mill’s criticism of traditional religious doctrines and institutions and his promotion of the “Religion of Humanity,” also depended largely on concerns about human cultivation and education. Though the Benthamite “philosophic radicals,” including Mill, took Christianity to be a particularly pernicious superstition that fostered indifference or hostility to human happiness (the keystone of utilitarian morality), Mill also thought that religion could potentially serve important ethical needs by supplying us with “ideal conceptions grander and more beautiful than we see realized in the prose of human life.” (CW, X.419). In so doing, religion elevates our feelings, cultivates sympathy with others, and imbues even our smallest activities with a sense of purpose.

The posthumously published three Essays on Religion (1874)—on “Nature,” the “Utility of Religion,” and “Theism”—criticized traditional religious views and formulated an alternative in the guise of the Religion of Humanity. Along with the criticism of religion’s moral effects that he shared with the Benthamites, Mill was also critical of the intellectual laziness that permitted belief in an omnipotent and benevolent God. He felt, following his father, that the world as we find it could not possibly have come from such a God given the evils rampant in it; either his power is limited or he is not wholly benevolent.

Beyond attacking arguments concerning the essence of God, Mill undermines a variety of arguments for his existence including all a priori arguments. He concludes that the only legitimate proof of God is an a posteriori and probabilistic argument from the design of the universe – the traditional argument (stemming from Aristotle) that complex features of the world, like the eye, are unlikely to have arisen by chance, hence there must be a designer. (Mill acknowledges the possibility that Darwin, in his 1859 The Origin of Species, has provided a wholly naturalistic explanation of such features, but he suggests that it is too early to judge of Darwin’s success).

Inspired by Comte, Mill finds an alternative to traditional religion in the Religion of Humanity, in which an idealized humanity becomes an object of reverence and the morally useful features of traditional religion are supposedly purified and accentuated. Humanity becomes an inspiration by being placed imaginatively within the drama of human history, which has a destination or point, namely the victory of good over evil. As Mill puts it, history should be seen as “the unfolding of a great epic or dramatic action,” which terminates “in the happiness or misery, the elevation or degradation, of the human race.” It is “an unremitting conflict between good and evil powers, of which every act done by any of us, insignificant as we are, forms one of the incidents.” (CW, XXI.244). As we begin to see ourselves as participants in this Manichean drama, as fighting alongside people like Socrates, Newton, and Jesus to secure the ultimate victory of good over evil, we become capable of greater sympathy, moral feeling, and an ennobled sense of the meaning of our own lives. The Religion of Humanity thereby acts as an instrument of human cultivation.

3. Conclusion

Mill’s intellect engaged with the world rather than fled from it. His was not an ivory tower philosophy, even when dealing with the most abstract of philosophical topics. His work is of enduring interest because it reflects how a fine mind struggled with and attempted to synthesize important intellectual and cultural movements. He stands at the intersections of conflicts between enlightenment and romanticism, liberalism and conservatism, and historicism and rationalism. In each case, as someone interested in conversation rather than pronouncement, he makes sincere efforts to move beyond polemic into sustained and thoughtful analysis. That analysis produced challenging answers to problems that still remain. Whether or not one agrees with his answers, Mill serves as a model for thinking about human problems in a serious and civilized way.

4. References and Further Reading

* = works of note.

Primary Texts

Bentham, Jeremy. Deontology together with A Table of the Springs of Action and The Article on Utilitarianism. Edited by Amnon Goldworth. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1983.
Bentham, Jeremy. An Introduction to the Principles of Morals and Legislation. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1996.
Bentham, Jeremy. The Works of Jeremy Bentham. Edited by John Bowring. 10 vols. New York: Russell and Russell, 1962.
Carlyle, Thomas. A Carlyle Reader. Edited by G.B. Tennyson. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1984.
Carlyle, Thomas. Critical and Miscellaneous Essays. Philadelphia: Casey and Hart, 1845.
Carlyle, Thomas. Past and Present. London: Ward, Lock, and Bowden, Ltd., 1897.
Coleridge, S.T.C. On the Constitution of the Church and State According to the Idea of Each (3rd Edition), and Lay Sermons (2nd Edition). London: William Pickering, 1839.
Comte, Auguste. A General View of Positivism. 1848. Reprint. Dubuque, Iowa: Brown Reprints, 1971.
Mill, James. An Analysis of the Phenomena of the Human Mind. Edited and with Notes by John Stuart Mill. London: Longmans, Green and Dyer, 1869.
*Mill, John Stuart. The Collected Works of John Stuart Mill. Gen. Ed. John M. Robson. 33 vols. Toronto: University of Toronto Press, 1963-91.
- The standard scholarly editions including Mill’s published works, letters, and notes; an outstanding resource.
Mill, John Stuart. A System of Logic. New York: Harper & Brothers, 1874.
Mill, John Stuart. On Liberty. Peterborough, Canada: Broadview Press, 1999.
Paley, William. The Principles of Moral and Political Philosophy. Indianapolis: Liberty Press, 2002 [1785].

Secondary Texts

Britton, Karl. ‘John Stuart Mill on Christianity.’ In James and John Stuart Mill: Papers of the Centenary Conference, John Robson and Michael Laine (eds.). Toronto: University of Toronto Press, 1976.
*Capaldi, Nicholas. John Stuart Mill: A Biography. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2004.
- A recent and very thorough treatment of Mill’s life and work.
Carlisle, Janice. John Stuart Mill and the Writing of Character. Athens, GA: University of Georgia Press, 1991.
Collini, Stefan. ‘The Idea of “Character” in Victorian Political Thought.’ Transactions of the Royal Historical Society, 5th series, 35 (1985), 29-50.
*Collini, Stefan. Public Moralists, Political Thought and Intellectual Life in Great Britain 1850-1930. Oxford: Clarendon, 1991.
- A useful history that includes discussion of Mill’s intellectual and institutional context.
*Collini, Stefan, Donald Winch, and John Burrow. That Noble Science of Politics: A Study in Nineteenth-century Intellectual History. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1983.
- Very valuable work on nineteenth century British political discourse; includes discussion of the Philosophic Radicals.
Donner, Wendy. The Liberal Self: John Stuart Mill’s Moral and Political Philosophy. Ithaca: Cornell Univ. Press, 1991.
Harrison, Brian. ‘State Intervention and Moral Reform in nineteeth-century England.’ In Pressure from Without in Early Victorian England, edited by Patricia Hollis, 289-322. New York: St. Martin’s Press, 1974.
*Halevy, Elie. The Growth of Philosophical Radicalism. Translated by Mary Morris. Boston: The Beacon Press, 1955.
- Though originally published in 1904, this is still a seminal work in the history of utilitarianism.
Hamburger, Joseph. ‘Religion and “On Liberty.”’ In A Cultivated Mind: Essays on J.S. Mill Presented to John M. Robson, edited by Michael Laine, 139-81. Toronto: Univ. of Toronto Press, 1961.
Harrison, Ross. Bentham. London: Routledge and Kegan Paul, 1983.
Hedley, Douglas. Coleridge, Philosophy and Religion: Aids to Reflection and the Mirror of the Spirit. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2000.
Heydt, Colin. ‘Narrative, Imagination, and the Religion of Humanity in Mill’s Ethics.’ Journal of the History of Philosophy, vol. 44, no. I (Jan. 2006), 99-115.
Heydt, Colin. ‘Mill, Bentham, and “Internal Culture”.’ British Journal for the History of Philosophy, vol. 14, no. 2 (May 2006), 275-302.
Heydt, Colin. Rethinking Mill’s Ethics: Character and Aesthetic Education. London: Continuum Press, 2006.
*Hollander, Samuel. The Economics of John Stuart Mill (Toronto: UTP and Oxford: Blackwell), 1985: Volume I, Theory and Method. Volume II, Political Economy, 482-1030.
- The seminal work on Mill’s economics.
Jenkyns, Richard. The Victorians and Ancient Greece. Cambridge, Mass.: Harvard University Press, 1980.
Jones, H. S. ‘John Stuart Mill as Moralist.’ Journal of the History of Ideas 53 (1992): 287-308.
Kuklick, Bruce. ‘Seven thinkers and how they grew: Descartes, Spinoza, Leibniz; Locke, Berkeley, Hume; Kant.’ In Philosophy in History, Rorty, Schneewind, Skinner (eds.). Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1984.
*Mandelbaum, M. History, Man and Reason. Baltimore: Johns Hopkins Univ. Press, 1971.
- An excellent intellectual history of Europe in the nineteenth century; contains very valuable discussions of Mill.
Matz, Lou. ‘The Utility of Religious Illusion: A Critique of J.S. Mill’s Religion of Humanity.’ Utilitas 12 (2000): 137-154.
Millar, Alan. ‘Mill on Religion.’ In The Cambridge Companion to Mill, John Skorupski (ed.). Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1998.
*Packe, Michael. The Life of John Stuart Mill. New York: MacMillan Company, 1954.
- Prior to Capaldi’s, the standard life; still contains useful biographical detail.
Raeder, Linda C. John Stuart Mill and the Religion of Humanity. Columbia: University of Missouri Press, 2002.
Robson, John M. The Improvement of Mankind: The Social and Political Thought of John Stuart Mill. Toronto: Toronto Univ. Press, 1968.
Robson, John. ‘J.S. Mill’s Theory of Poetry.’ In Mill: A Collection of Critical Essays, J. B. Schneewind, (ed.). London: MacMillan, 1968.
Ryan, Alan. The Philosophy of John Stuart Mill. London: MacMillan, 1970.
*Ryan, Alan. J.S. Mill. London: Routledge and Kegan Paul, 1974.
- A nice introduction to Mill’s writings and central arguments.
*Schneewind, J. B. Sidgwick’s Ethics and Victorian Moral Philosophy. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1977.
- Still easily the best extant treatment of Victorian moral philosophy; includes extremely valuable examination of the conflict between utilitarianism and intuitionism.
Sen, Amartya, and Bernard Williams, eds. Utilitarianism and Beyond. Cambridge: Cambridge Univ. Press, 1982.
Shanely, Mary Lyndon. ‘Marital Slavery and Friendship: John Stuart Mill’s The Subjection of Women.’ Political Theory, Vol. 9, No. 2 (May 1981), 229-247.
Shanley, Mary Lyndon. ‘Suffrage, Protective Labor Legislation, and Married Women’s Property Laws in England.’ Signs, Vol. 12, No. 1 (1986).
*Skorupski, John. John Stuart Mill. London: Routledge, 1989.
- Unquestionably, the best single book on Mill’s general philosophy.
Skorupski, John. ‘Introduction.’ In The Cambridge Companion to Mill, edited by John Skorupski. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1998.
*Skorupski, John (editor). The Cambridge Companion to Mill. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1998.
- Includes a number of important articles and an extensive (though by now a little dated) bibliography.
Smart, J.J.C. ‘Extreme and Restricted Utilitarianism.’ The Philosophical Quarterly, (October 1956), 344-354.
*Thomas, William. The Philosophic Radicals: Nine Studies in Theory and Practice 1817-1841. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1979.
- Very good resource for Philosophic Radicalism.
Turner, Michael J. “Radical Opinion in an Age of Reform: Thomas Perronet Thompson and the Westminster Review,” History, Vol. 86 (2001), Issue 281, 18-40.
Williams, Raymond. Culture and Society 1780-1950. New York: Columbia University Press, 1983.
*Wilson, Fred. Psychological Analysis and the Philosophy of John Stuart Mill. Toronto: Toronto Univ. Press, 1990.
- Most thorough treatment of Mill’s psychological views.

Author Information

Colin Heydt
Email: cheydt@cas.usf.edu
University of South Florida
U. S. A.

Anselm of Canterbury (1033—1109)

anselm Saint Anselm was one of the most important Christian thinkers of the eleventh century. He is most famous in philosophy for having discovered and articulated the so-called “ontological argument;” and in theology for his doctrine of the atonement. However, his work extends to many other important philosophical and theological matters, among which are: understanding the aspects and the unity of the divine nature; the extent of our possible knowledge and understanding of the divine nature; the complex nature of the will and its involvement in free choice; the interworkings of human willing and action and divine grace; the natures of truth and justice; the natures and origins of virtues and vices; the nature of evil as negation or privation; and the condition and implications of original sin.

In the course of his work and thought, unlike most of his contemporaries, Anselm deployed argumentation that was in most respects only indirectly dependent on Sacred Scripture, Christian doctrine, and tradition. Anselm also developed sophisticated analyses of the language used in discussion and investigation of philosophical and theological issues, highlighting the importance of focusing on the meaning of the terms used rather than allowing oneself to be misled by the verbal forms, and examining the adequacy of the language to the objects of investigation, particularly to the divine nature. In addition, in his work he both discussed and exemplified the resolution of apparent contradictions or paradoxes by making appropriate distinctions. For these reasons, one title traditionally accorded him is the Scholastic Doctor, since his approach to philosophical and theological matters both represents and contributed to early medieval Christian Scholasticism.

Life
Influences
Methodology: Faith and Reason
The Proslogion
Gaunilo’s Reply and Anselm’s Response
The Monologion
Cur Deus Homo
De Grammatico
The De Veritate
The De Libertate Arbitrii
The De Casu Diaboli
The De Concordia
The Fragments
Other Writings
References and Further Readings
1. Primary Sources
2. Secondary Sources

1. Life

Anselm was born in 1033 in Aosta, a border town of the kingdom of Burgundy. In his adolescence, he decided that there was no better life than the monastic one. He sought to become a monk, but was refused by the abbot of the local monastery. Leaving his birthplace as a young man, he headed north across the Alps to France, eventually arriving at Bec in Normandy, where he studied under the eminent theologian and dialectician Lanfranc, whose involvement in disputes with Berengar spurred a revival in theological speculation and application of dialectic in theological argument. At the monastery of Bec, Anselm devoted himself to scholarship, and found an earlier childhood attraction to the monastic life reawakening. Unable to decide between becoming a monk at Bec or Cluny, becoming a hermit, or living off his inheritance and giving alms to the poor, he put the decision in the hands of Lanfranc and Maurilius, the Archbishop of Rouen, who decided Anselm should enter monastic life at Bec, which he did in 1060.

In 1063, after Lanfranc left Bec for Caen, Anselm was chosen to be prior. Among the various tasks Anselm took on as prior was that of instructing the monks, but he also had time left for carrying on rigorous spiritual exercises, which would play a great role in his philosophical and theological development. As his biographer, Eadmer, writes: “being continually given up to God and to spiritual exercises, he attained such a height of divine speculation that he was able by God’s help to see into and unravel many most obscure and previously insoluble questions…” (1962, p. 12). He became particularly well known, both in the monastic community and in the wider community, not only for the range and depth of his insight into human nature, the virtues and vices, and the practice of moral and religious life, but also for the intensity of his devotions and asceticism.

In 1070, Anselm began to write, particularly prayers and meditations, which he sent to monastic friends and to noblewomen for use in their own private devotions. He also engaged in a great deal of correspondence, leaving behind numerous letters. Eventually, his teaching and thinking culminated in a set of treatises and dialogues. In 1077, he produced the Monologion, and in 1078 the Proslogion. Eventually, Anselm was elected abbot of the monastery. At some time while still at Bec, Anselm wrote the De Veritate (On Truth), De Libertate Arbitrii (On Freedom of Choice), De Casu Diaboli (On the Fall of the Devil), and De Grammatico.

In 1092, Anselm traveled to England, where Lanfranc had previously been arch-bishop of Canterbury. The Episcopal seat had been kept vacant so King William Rufus could collect its income, and Anselm was proposed as the new bishop, a prospect neither the king nor Anselm desired. Eventually, the king fell ill, changed his mind in fear of his demise, and nominated Anselm to become bishop. Anselm attempted to argue his unfitness for the post, but eventually accepted. In addition to the typical cares of the office, his tenure as arch-bishop of Canterbury was marked by nearly uninterrupted conflict over numerous issues with King William Rufus, who attempted not only to appropriate church lands, offices, and incomes, but even to have Anselm deposed. Anselm had to go into exile and travel to Rome to plead the case of the English church to the Pope, who not only affirmed Anselm’s position, but refused Anselm’s own request to be relieved of his office. While archbishop in exile, however, Anselm did finish his Cur Deus Homo, also writing the treatises Epistolae de Incarnatione Verbi (On the Incarnation of the Word), De Conceptu Virginali et de Originali Peccato (On the Virgin Conception and on Original Sin), De Processione Spiritus Sancti (On the Proceeding of the Holy Spirit), and De Concordia Praescientia et Praedestinationis et Gratiae Dei cum Libero Arbitrio (On the Harmony of the Foreknowledge, the Predestination, and the Grace of God with Free Choice).

Upon returning to England after William Rufus’s death, conflict eventually ensued between the archbishop and the new king, Henry I, requiring Anselm once again to travel to Rome. When judgment was made by Pope Paschal II in Anselm’s favor, the king forbade him to return to England, but eventually reconciliation took place. Anselm died in 1109, leaving behind several pupils and friends of some importance, among them Eadmer, Anselm’s biographer, and the theologian Gilbert Crispin. He was declared a doctor of the Roman Catholic Church in 1720, and is considered a saint by the Roman Catholic Church and the churches in the Anglican Communion.

Today, Anselm is most well known for his Proslogion proof for the existence of God, but his thought was widely known in the Middle Ages, and still today in certain circles of scholarship, particularly among religious scholars, for considerably more than that single achievement. For fuller biographies of Anselm, see Eadmer’s Vita Sancti Anselmi/ The Life of St. Anselm: Archbishop of Canterbury, and Alexander’s Liber ex dictis beati Anselmi.

2. Influences

With the exception of St. Augustine, and to a lesser extent Boethius, it is difficult to definitively ascribe the influence of other thinkers to the development of St. Anselm’s thought. To be sure, Anselm studied under Lanfranc, but Lanfranc does not appear to have been a significant influence on the actual content or expression of Anselm’s thought, and he largely ignored Lanfranc’s misgivings about the method of theMonologion. Anselm cites Boethius, but does not draw upon him extensively. Other figures have been proposed as influences on Anselm, for instance John Scotus Eriugena and Pseudo-Dionysus, but any such proposals are set in the proper framework by these remarks from Koyré: “The influence of these two great thinkers is not at all lacking in verisimilitude a priori.” (Koyré 1923, 109). It is possible that either one of them, or other thinkers, influenced Anselm, but going beyond mere possibility given the texts we possess is controversial.

Discerning influences on Anselm’s work is for the most part conjectural, precisely because Anselm makes so few references to previous thinkers in his work. In the preface to the Monologion he writes: “Reexamining the work often myself, I have been able to find nothing that I have said in it, that would not agree [cohaereat] with the writings of the Catholic Fathers and especially with those of the blessed Augustine.” (S. v. 1, p.8)

[All citations of Anselm’s texts (except for the Fragments) are the author’s translations from S. Anselmi Cantuariensis Archepiscopi Opera Omnia, abbreviated here as S., followed by (when needed) the volume and the page numbers. Latin terms in brackets or parentheses have been romanized to current orthography. All citations of the Fragments are the author’s translations from the Ein neues unvollendetes Werk des heilige Anselm von Canterbury, henceforth abbreviated as u.W.]

Anselm references Augustine’s On the Holy Trinity, but as a whole work, giving no specific references. Clearly, Augustine was a major influence on Anselm’s thought, but that is in itself rather unremarkable, since practically all of his contemporaries fit in one way or another into the broad stream of the Augustinian tradition. As Southern summarizes the issues: “[T]he ambivalence of Anselm’s relations to St. Augustine remains one of the mysteries of his mind and personality. Augustine’s thought was the pervading atmosphere in which Anselm moved; but he was never content merely to reproduce Augustine.” (1963, 32)

In fact, one of the most important features of Anselm’s work is its originality. As Southern has also pointed out, this originality was not confined to the treatises and dialogues. In his more devotional prayers and meditations, Anselm adapted traditional forms to new content, (1963, 34-47) “open[ing] the way which led to the Dies Irae, the Imitatio Christi, and the masterpieces of later medieval piety.” (1963, 47) Although clearly indebted to an Augustinian (neo)-Platonic tradition often termed “Christian philosophy,” Anselm’s originality clearly furthered and expanded that tradition, and prepared the way for later Scholasticism. The term “Christian philosophy” was used in a variety of senses, particularly within and to denote the Augustinian tradition, and was applied to Anselm’s work by numerous interpreters. A set of debates, which gave rise to a sizable literature, and which are still to some extent being continued today, took place in Francophone circles (spreading to German, Italian, Spanish, and English-speaking circles in later years) in the early 1930s, about the nature and possibility of “Christian philosophy.” One of the main participants, Etienne Gilson, in fact used Anselm’s formula fides quaerens intellectum several times as one of the definitions of Christian philosophy.

Anselm’s work was influential for some of his contemporaries, and has continued to exercise influence in varying ways on philosophers and theologians to the present day. The so-called “ontological argument” has had numerous critics, defenders, and adaptors philosophically or theologically notable in their own right, among them St. Bonaventure, St. Thomas Aquinas, Descartes, Gassendi, Spinoza, Malebranche, Locke, Leibniz, Kant, Hegel, and an even greater number in the last century, not least of which were Charles Hartshorne, Etienne Gilson, Maurice Blondel, Martin Heidegger, Karl Barth, Norman Malcolm, and Alvin Plantinga. However, the “argument”(s) discussed in this literature are frequently not precisely what is found in Anselm’s texts, and a sizable literature has developed addressing that very issue.

Argument(s) for God’s being or existence form only a small portion of Anselm’s considerable and complex work, and his influence has been much wider and deeper than originating one perennial line of philosophical investigation and discussion. In his own time, he had several gifted students, among them Anselm of Laon, Gilbert Crispin, Eadmer (writer of the Vita Anselmi), Alexander (writer of the Dicta Anselmi), and Honorius Augustodunensis. His works were copied and disseminated in his lifetime, and exercised an influence on later Scholastics, among them Bonaventure, Thomas Aquinas, John Duns Scotus, and William of Ockham. For further discussion of Anselm’s influence, cf. Châtillon, 1959, Southern, 1963, Rovighi, 1964, Hopkins, 1972, and Fortin, 2001.

3. Methodology: Faith and Reason

The extent to which Anselm’s work, and which portions of it, ought to be considered to be philosophy or theology (or “philosophical theology,” “Christian philosophy,” and so forth) is a long debated question. The answers (and their rationales) depend considerably on one’s conceptions of philosophy and theology and their distinction and interaction. These admittedly important issues are set aside here in order to focus on three key features of Anselm’s work: Anselm’s pedagogical motivation and his intended audience; the notion of faith seeking understanding (fides quaerens intellectum); and Anselm’s stylistics and dialectic.

Anselm provides a paradigmatic account of the pedagogical motive structuring his works in theMonologion’s Prologue.

Some of the brothers have often and earnestly entreated me to set down in writing for them some of the matters I have brought to light for them when we spoke together in our accustomed discourses, about how the divine essence ought to be meditated upon and certain other things pertaining to that sort of meditation, as a kind of model for meditation…. They prescribed this form for me: nothing whatsoever in these matters should be made convincing [persuaderetur] by the authority of Scripture, but whatsoever the conclusion [finis], through individual investigations, should assert…the necessity of reason would concisely prove [cogeret], and the clarity of truth would evidently show that this is the case. They also wished that I not disdain to meet and address [obviare] simpleminded and almost foolish objections that occurred to me. (S. v. 1, p.7)

The original audience for his writings was fellow Benedictine monks seeking a fuller understanding of the Christian faith and asking that Anselm provide an articulation of it in a form quite different than those typical and traditional of their time, namely, where such theological discussions were carried out primarily through citation and interpretation of Scripture and patristic authorities. Anselm expresses this pedagogical motive again in the Cur Deus Homo: “I have often and most earnestly been asked by many, in speech and in writing, to commit in writing to posterity [memoriae. . commendem] reasonable answers [rationes] I am accustomed to give to those asking about a certain question of our faith.” (S. v. 2, p.47)

The goal of Anselm’s treatises is not to provide a philosophical substitute for the Christian faith, nor to rationalize or systematize it solely in the light of natural reason. Rather, in the cases of the Monologionand Proslogion, he aims to treat meditatively, by reason’s resources, central aspects of the Christian faith, namely, as he puts it in the Proslogion’s Prologue: “that God truly is, and that he is the supreme good needing no other, and that he is what all things need so that they are and so that they are well, and whatever else we believe about the divine substance.” (S., v. 1, p. 93) In the other treatises (excepting theDe Grammatico, which he explicitly states to be for “beginners in dialectic,” and that it “pertains to a different subject matter than [Sacred Scripture],” S., v.1, p. 173), Anselm concerns himself with other important, and often interrelated, aspects of the Christian faith, developing the arguments through reasoning, rather than through explicit reliance on Scriptural or patristic authority in the course of argumentation. Over the course of his career, Anselm’s intended audience expands considerably, however, particularly as he became involved in controversy over the Trinity that culminated in hisEpistola de Incarnatione Verbi and Cur Deus Homo.

The Proslogion’s Prologue provides a somewhat different, but clearly related motive for its production. After the Monologion, Anselm writes: “considering that that work was constructed from an interlinking [concatenatione] of many arguments, I began to wonder if perhaps a single argument [unum argumentum] that needed nothing other than itself alone for proving itself.” (S., v. 1, p. 93) Once he had uncovered this unum argumentum (“single argument”) after great effort and difficulty, Anselm wrote about it and several other related topics, in the interest of sharing the joy it had brought him, or at least pleasing another who would read it (alicui legenti placiturum).

Precisely what this single argument consists of has been a subject of considerable scholarly debate. A fairly common but clearly incorrect interpretation of the “single argument” takes it as referring only to the proof for God’s existence or being in Chapter 2, or at most Chapters 2-4. At the other extreme, some commentators take the single argument to be the entirety of the Proslogion. A third, intermediary position argues that the unum argumentum is the entirety of the Proslogion, minus the last three chapters, for two reasons: 1) Anselm calls the last three chapters coniectationes; 2) Anselm says in the prooemium that he wrote the Proslogion about the argument itself (de hoc ipso) and about several other things (et de quibusdam aliis).

As Anselm explains to his interlocutor Boso, his writing the De Conceptu Virginali is motivated by a purpose similar to that of the Proslogion, reexamining and rearticulating topics previously addressed in other works.

For I am certain that when you read in the Cur Deus Homo. . . that, besides the one I set down there, another reason can be glimpsed [posse uideri], how God took on humanity without sin from the sinful mass of the human race, your most studious mind will be driven not a little to asking what this reason is. Accordingly, I feared that I would appear unjust to you if I conceal what I think on this [quod inde mihi videtur] from your enjoyment [dilectioni tuae]. (S., v. 2, p. 139)

The prologue to the three connected dialogues (De Veritate, De Libertate Arbitrii, De Casu Diaboli) does not indicate conclusively whether they were written to answer specific requests of the monks. Clearly, however, they treat matters of both theological and philosophical interest arising out of reflection and discussion on Christian faith, life, and thought.

Fides quaerens intellectum, “faith seeking understanding” was the Proslogion’s original title and is an apt designation for Anselm’s philosophical and theological projects as a whole. Anselm begins from, and never leaves the standpoint of a committed and practicing Catholic Christian, but this does not mean that his philosophical work is thereby vitiated as philosophy by operating on the basis of and within the confines of theological presuppositions. Rather, Anselm engages in philosophy, employing reasoning rather than appeal to Scriptural or patristic authority in order to establish the doctrines of the Christian faith (which, as a faithful and practicing believer, he takes as already established) in a different, but possible way, through the employment of reason. Faith seeking understanding goes beyond simply establishing faith’s doctrines, however, precisely because it seeks understanding, the rational intelligibility (as far as is possible) of the doctrines.

Anselm does cite Scripture at certain points in his work, as well as “what we believe” (quod credimus), but attention to his texts indicates that he does not rely on scriptural or doctrinal authority directly to resolve problems or to provide starting points for his reasoning. In some cases, he has the student or his own questioning voice (as in Proslogion, Chapter 8) bring up Scriptural passages of truths of Christian doctrine in order to raise problems that require a rational resolution. In other cases (as in De Concordia, Book 1 Chapter 5), he does use Scriptural passages as starting points for arguments, but for erroneous arguments that he then criticizes. In yet other cases, Anselm brings up Scripture precisely to explain how certain passages or expressions should be rightly understood (as in the De Casu Diaboli, explaining how God causing evil should be understood). Lastly, Anselm cites Scripture after the course of his argument in order to reconnect the rational argumentation with Christian revelation (as in Proslogion, Chapter 16, where Anselm’s previous reasoning culminates in God “inhabiting” an “inaccessible light”). For discussion of Anselm and Scripture, cf. Barth, 1960, Tonini, 1970, and Henry, 1962.

In his actual exercise of reason, Anselm displays both confidence in reason’s capacity for providing understanding to faith, and awareness of the limitations human reason’s exercise eventually runs into and becomes aware of. For instance, in Proslogion, Chapter 15, he concludes that God is not only that than which nothing greater can be thought, but something greater than can be thought. Another important aspect of Anselm’s fides quaerens intellectum is that, in the Monologion, reason is employed by one who “disputes and investigates with himself things he had not previously taken notice of [non animadvertisset],” (S., v. 1, p. 8) and in the Proslogion, one “striving to raise his mind to the contemplation of God, and seeking to understand what he believes.” (S., v. 1, p. 94)

Despite Anselm’s deliberate employment of reason as a means to the truth about both the natural and the supernatural order, his rationalism is a mitigated one. Monologion Chapter 1 exemplifies this. Anselm’s assessment is that one could persuade oneself of the truths argued for in the Monologion by the use of one’s reason, but Anselm hastens to add: “I wish it to be understood [accipi] that, even if a conclusion is reached [concludatur] seemingly as necessary [quasi necessarium] from reasons that seem good to me, it is not that it is entirely [omnino] necessary, but only that for the current time [interim] it be said to be able to appear necessary.” (S., v. 1, p.14)

Chapter 64 of the Monologion provides another important discussion of the use of reason and argument. Anselm distinguishes between being able to understand or explain that something is true or that something exists, and being able to understand or explain how something is true. Since the divine substance, the triune God is ultimately beyond the capacities of human understanding, reason, or more precisely the reasoning human subject, must recognize both the limits and the capacities of reason.

I think that for someone investigating an incomprehensible matter it ought to be sufficient, if by reasoning towards it, he arrives at knowing that it most certainly does exist, even if he is unable to go further by use of the intellect [penetrare. . . intellectu] into how it is this way. Nor for that reason should we withhold the certainty of faith from those things that are asserted through necessary proofs [probationibus], and that are inconsistent with no other reason, if because of the incomprehensibility of their natural sublimity they do not allow themselves [non patiuntur] to be explained. (S., v. 1, p. 75)

Anselm is not skeptically questioning or undermining the capacities of reason and argumentation. Not every possible object the intellect attempts to engage with presents such problems, but only God. Accordingly, although a completely full and exhaustively systematic account cannot be provided of the divine substance, this does not undermine the certainty of what reason has been able to determine.

Stylistically, Anselm’s treatises take two basic forms, dialogues and sustained meditations. The former represent pedagogical discussions between a fairly gifted and inquisitive pupil and a teacher. In the latter, Anselm provides, as noted earlier, models of meditation, but the model differs considerably from theMonologion to the Proslogion, for in the first treatise, Anselm aims to provide a model of a person meditating, or (using Aristotle’s conception) engaging in dialectic with himself, while in the second case, the person addresses himself to the very God that he is attempting to comprehend as best as human capacities allow.

In the dialogue Cur Deus Homo, a student, Boso, “my brother and most beloved son” (S., v. 2, p. 139) is called by name. In the majority of the dialogues, the student and teacher are not named; it is clear, however, that the teacher represents Anselm and presents Anselm’s doctrines. The De Conceptu Virginali and the De Concordia are not written in the same dialogue form as the other treatises, but they are dialogical in their narrative voice(s), since Anselm addresses himself to another person (in the De Conceptu Virginali to Boso), articulating possible problems and objections his reader might make in order to address them.

The dialogue form serves a pedagogical purpose and reflects the project of fides quaerens intellectum, exemplified well by this passage from the De Casu Diaboli: “[L]et it not weary you to briefly reply to my silly questioning [fatuae interrogationi], so that I might know how I should respond to someone asking me the very same thing. Indeed, it is not always easy to respond wisely [sapienter] to someone who is asking foolishly [insipienter].” (S., v. 1, p. 275)

Interestingly, it appears that a recurring problem for Anselm was his treatises being copied and circulated without his authorization and before their final and finished state. He asserts this to be the case with the three connected dialogues and the Cur Deus Homo.

The following sections provide discussions of, and excerpts from, many of Anselm’s key works. With the exception of the Proslogion, Monologion, and Cur Deus Homo, the works are examined in chronological order (as best as we know it). These three works are discussed first and in this order because the Proslogion has garnered the most attention from philosophers (more than the earlierMonologion, with which it shares similar aims and content) and the Cur Deus Homo likewise has garnered more attention from theologians than the earlier three dialogues “pertaining to study of Sacred Scripture” (S., v.1, p. 173) (the De Veritate, De Libertate Arbitrii, and De Casu Diaboli).

4. The Proslogion

In the Proslogion, Anselm intended to replace the many interconnected arguments from his previous and much longer work, the Monologion, with a single argument. Since the unum argumentum is supposed to prove not only that God exists, but other matters about God as well, as noted above, there is some scholarly controversy as to exactly what the argument is in the Proslogion’s text. Clearly, the so-called “ontological argument” for God’s existence in Chapter 2 plays a central role. It must be pointed out that Anselm nowhere uses the term “ontological argument,” nor in fact do the critics or proponents of the argument until Kant’s time. It has unfortunately become so ingrained in our philosophical vocabulary, especially in Anglophone Anselm scholarship, however, that it would be pedantic to insist on not using it at all. An interesting and sizable recent literature has developed explicitly contesting the appellation “ontological” applied to Anselm’s Proslogion proof(s) of God’s being or existence, a partial bibliography of which is provided in McEvoy, 1994.

Noting that God is believed to be something than which nothing greater can be thought (quo maius cogitari non potest), Anselm asks whether such a thing exists, since the Fool of the Psalms has said in his heart that there is no God.

But certainly that very same Fool, when he hears this very expression I say [hoc ipsum quod dico]: “something than which nothing greater can be thought,” understands what he hears; and what he understands is in his understanding [in intellectu], even if he does not understand that thing to exist. For it is one thing to be in the understanding, and another to understand a thing to exist. . . . . Therefore even the fool is compelled to admit [convincitur] that there is in his understanding something than which nothing greater can be thought, since when he hears this he understands it, and whatever is understood is in the understanding. And certainly that than which a greater cannot be thought cannot exist in the understanding alone. For if it is in the intellect alone [in solo intellectu], it can be thought to also be in reality [in re], which is something greater. If, therefore, that than which a greater cannot be thought is in the intellect alone, that very thing than which a greater cannot be thought is that than which a greater can be thought. But surely that cannot be. Therefore, without a doubt, something than which a greater cannot be thought exists [exsistit] both in the understanding and in reality. (S., v. 1, p. 101-2)

In Chapter 3, Anselm continues the argumentation, providing what some commentators take to be a second ontological argument.

And, it so truly exists that it cannot be thought not to be. For, a thing, which cannot be thought not to be (which is greater than what cannot be thought not to be), can be thought to be. So, if that than which a greater cannot be thought can be thought not to be, that very thing than which a greater cannot be thought is not that than which a greater cannot be thought, which cannot be compatible [convenire, i.e. with the thing being such]. Therefore, there truly is something than which a greater cannot be thought, and it cannot be thought not to be. (S., p. 102-3)

Addressing himself to God, Anselm explains why God cannot be thought not to exist, indicating why God uniquely has this status. “[I]f some mind could think something better than you, the creature would ascend over the Creator, and would engage in judgment about the Creator, which is quite absurd. And anything else whatsoever other than yourself can be thought not to exist. For you alone are the most true of all things, and thus you have being to the greatest degree [maxime], for anything else is not so truly [as God], and for this reason has less of being.” (S., p. 103) This raises a puzzle, however. Why does the Fool not only doubt whether God exists, but assert that there is no God? One possible, but rather circular answer is provided at the end of Chapter 3. “Why else, except because he is stupid and a fool?” (S., p. 103) As Anselm knows, however, that does not really answer the question. Chapter 4 provides an answer. The Fool both does and does not think [cogitare] that God does not exist, since there are two senses of “think”:

A thing is thought of in one way when one thinks of the word [vox] signifying it, in another way when what the thing itself is is understood. Therefore, in the first way it can be thought that God does not exist, but in the second way not at all. Indeed no one who understands that which God is can think that God is not, even though he says these words in his heart, either without any signification or with some other signification not properly applying to God [aliqua extranea significatione]. (S., p. 103-104)

Proslogion Chapters 5-26 deal progressively with the divine attributes, 5-23 either continuing or building off of the argument, and 24-26 being connected conjectures about God’s goodness. In Chapter 5, Anselm deduces attributes of God from the same “than which nothing greater can be thought” he used in Chapters 2-4.

What then are you, Lord God, that than which nothing greater can be thought? But what are you if not that which is the greatest of all things, who alone exists through himself, who made everything else from nothing? For whatever is not this, is less than what can be thought. But this cannot be thought about you. For what good is lacking to the supreme good, through which every good thing is? And so, you are just, truthful, happy, and whatever it is better to be than not to be. (S., p. 104)

These attributes of God, what it is better to be than not to be, are filled out in Chapter 6 (percipient, omnipotent, merciful, impassible), Chapter 11 (living, wise, good, happy, eternal), and Chapter 18 (an unity).

In Chapter 18, Anselm argues from God’s superlative unity to the unity of his attributes. “[Y]ou are so much a kind of unity [unum quiddam] and identical to yourself, that you are dissimilar to yourself in no way; indeed, you are that very unity, divisible by no understanding. Therefore, life and wisdom and the other [attributes] are not parts of you but all of them are one, and each of them is entirely what you are, and what the other [attributes] are.” (S., p. 115)

In Chapter 23, he employs this notion of superlative unity to explain how God can be a Trinity, indicating that all of the persons of the Trinity share equally and completely in the divine attributes. In the divine unity, the second person of the Trinity, the Son, or the Word is coequal to the first person, “Truly, there cannot be anything other than what you are, or anything greater or lesser than you in the Word by which you speak yourself; for your Word is true [verum] in the same way that you are truthful [quomodo tu verax], and for that reason he is the very same truth as you, not other than you.” (S., p. 117) The same holds for the third person of the Trinity, which is “the one love, common to you and your Son, that is, the Holy Spirit who proceeds from both.” (S., p. 117) Accordingly, for each of the persons of the Trinity, “what any of them is individually is at the same time the entire Trinity, the Father and the Son and the Holy Spirit; for, any one of them individually is not something other than the supremely simple unity and the supremely one simplicity, which cannot be multiplied or be one thing different from another.” (S., p. 117)

There are five other main matters that Anselm addresses in the Proslogion, the first three of which are sets of problems stemming from seeming incompatibilities in the divine attributes. Anselm puts these questions in Chapter 6. “How can you be perceptive [es sensibilis] if you are not a body? How can you be omnipotent, if you cannot do everything? How can you be merciful and impassible at the same time?” (S., p. 104) Anselm deals with the first briefly in Chapter 6, proposing that perceiving is knowing (cognoscere) or aimed at knowing (ad cognoscendum), so that God is supremely perceptive without knowing things through the type of sensibility human beings and animals have.

The argumentation of Chapter 7 is particularly important. There are things that God cannot do, for instance lying, being corrupted, making what is true to be false or what has been done to not be done. It seems that a truly omnipotent being ought to be able to do these things. To be able to do such things, Anselm suggests, is not really to have a power (potentia), but really a kind of powerlessness (impotentia). “For one who can do these things, can do what is not advantageous to oneself and what one ought not do. The more a person can do these things, the more adversity and perversity can do against that person, and the less that person can do against these.” (S., p. 105) So, one who does these things does them through powerlessness, through having one’s agency subjected to that of something other, rather than through one’s power. This, as Anselm explains, relies on an inexact manner of speaking, where one expresses powerlessness or inability as a kind of power or ability

In Chapters 8-11, through a longer and more sustained argument, Anselm answers the third question explaining how God can be both merciful and just at the same time. The explanation rests on God’s mercy stemming from his goodness, which is not ultimately something different from God’s justice, and which can be reconciled with it. Anselm concludes in Chapter 12: “But certainly, whatever you are, you are not through another but through yourself. Accordingly, you are the very life by which you live, and the wisdom by which you are wise, and the goodness by which you are good to good people and bad people; and likewise with similar attributes.” (S., p. 110) For God to be merciful to, forgive, and therefore not render justice to all transgressors, or likewise for God to not extend mercy, forgive, and therefore render justice to all transgressors would be for God to be something lesser than He is. It is, in effect, greater to be able to be just and merciful at the same time, which is possible for God precisely because justice and goodness coincide only in God. At the same time, Anselm concedes that when it comes to understanding precisely why God mercifully forgives of justly rendered judgment in a particular case is beyond our human capacities. For further discussion of Chapters 8-11, cf. Bayart, 1937, Corbin, 1988, and Sadler, 2006.

The fourth main issue, discussed in Chapters 14-17, has to do with our limited knowledge of God, which stems both from human sinfulness and God’s dazzling splendor. Again, as in Chapter 4, one can say that something is and is not the case at the same time, because it is being said in different and distinguishable ways. “If [my soul] did not see you [God], then it did not see the light or the truth. But, is not the truth and the light what it saw and yet did it still not yet see you, since it saw you only in a certain way [aliquatenus] but did not see you exactly as you are [sicuti es]?” (S., p. 111)

The reason the human soul does not see God directly is twofold, stemming both from finite human nature and from infinite divine nature. “But certainly [the human mind] is darkened in itself, and it is dazzled [reverbetur] by you. It is obscured by its own shortness of view [sua brevitate], and it is overwhelmed by your immensity. Truly it is restricted [contrahitur] in by its own narrowness, and it is overcome [vincitur] by your grandeur.” (S., p. 112) For this reason, in Chapter 15, Anselm concludes that God is in fact “greater than can be thought” (maior quam cogitari potest).

Finally, in Chapters 18-21, Anselm discusses God’s eternity. Anselm first indicates that God’s eternity is such that God is entirely present whenever and wherever God is, which is to say everywhere and at all times. Then, in Chapter 19, he begins to articulate the implications of God’s eternity more fully, ultimately leading into a transformation of perspective. Just as it is not the case that there is eternity and God happens to be in and is therefore eternal, since the reality is that God is eternity itself, God is not in every time or place, but rather everything, all times and places, is in God, that is, in God’s eternity.

5. Gaunilo’s Reply and Anselm’s Response

Gaunilo, a monk from the Abbey of Marmoutier, while noting the value of the remainder of theProslogion, attacked its argument for God’s existence on several counts. His arguments prefigure many arguments made by later philosophers against ontological arguments for God’s existence, and Anselm’s responses provide additional insight into the Proslogion argument. Gaunilo makes four main objections, and in each case, Gaunilo transposes Anselm’s “that than which nothing greater can be thought” into “that which is greater than everything else that can be thought.”

Gaunilo asserts that an additional argument is needed to move from this being having been thought to it being impossible for it not to be. “It needs to be proven to me by some other undoubtable argument that this being is of such a sort that as soon as it is thought its undoubtable existence is perceived with certainty by the understanding.” (S., v. 1, p. 126) He brings up this need for a further, unsupplied, argument twice more in his Reply, and in the last instance discusses what is really at issue. The Fool can say: “[W]hen did I say that in the truth of the matter [rei veritate] there was such a thing that is ‘greater than everything?’ For first, by some other completely certain argument, some superior nature must be proven to exist, that is, one greater or better than everything that exists, so that from this we could prove all the other things that cannot be lacking to what is greater or better than everything else.” (S., p. 129)

A second problem is whether one can actually understand what is supposed to be understood in order for the argument to work because God is unlike any creature, anything that we have knowledge or a conception of . “When I hear ‘that which is greater than everything that can be thought,’ which cannot be said to be anything other than God himself, I cannot think it or have it in the intellect on the basis of something I know from its species or genus. . . . For I neither know the thing itself, nor can I form an idea of it from something similar.” (S., p. 126-7)

Gaunilo continues along this line, arguing that the verbal formula employed in the argument is merely that, a verbal formula. The formula cannot really be understood, so it does not then really exist in the understanding. The signification or meaning of the terms can be thought, “but not as by a person who knows what is typically signified by this expression [voce], i.e. by one who thinks it on the basis of a thing that is true at least in thought alone.” (S., p. 127) Instead, what is actually being thought, according to Gaunilo, is vague. The signification or meaning of the terms is grasped only in a groping manner. “[I]t is thought as by one who does not know the thing and simply thinks on the basis of a movement of the mind produced by hearing this expression, trying to picture to himself the meaning of the expression perceived.” (S., p. 127) From this, Gaunilo concludes what he takes to be a denial of one of the premises of the argument: “So much then for the notion that that supreme nature is said to already exist in my understanding.” (S., p. 127)

A third problem that Gaunilo raises is that the argument could be applied to things other than God, things that are clearly imaginary, so that, if the argument were valid, it could be used to prove much more than Anselm intended, namely falsities. Here, the example of the Lost Island is introduced. “You can no longer doubt that this island excelling [praestantiorem] all other lands truly exists somewhere in reality, this island that you do not doubt to exist in your understanding; and since it is more excellent not to be in the understanding alone but also to be in reality, so it is necessary that it exists, since, if it did not, any other land that exists in reality would be more excellent than it.” (S., p. 128)

Anselm’s responses are long, detailed, and dense. Anselm notes Gaunillo’s alteration of the terms of the argument, and that this affects the force of the argument.

You repeat often that I say that, because what is greater than everything else [maius omnibus] is in the understanding, if it is the understanding it is in reality – for otherwise what is greater than everything else would not be greater than everything else – but such a proof [probatio] is found nowhere in all of the things I have said. For, saying “that which is greater than all” and “that than which nothing greater can be thought” do not have the same value for proving that what is being talked about is in reality. (S., p. 134)Therefore if, from what is said to be “greater than everything,” what “that than which nothing greater can be thought” proves of itself through itself [de se per seipsum] cannot be proved in a similar way, you have unjustly criticized me for having said what I did not say, when this differs so much from what I did say. (S., p. 135)

In Anselm’s view, Gaunilo demands a further argument precisely because he has not understood the argument as Anselm presented it. Anselm also affirms that we can understand the meaning of the term, “that than which nothing greater can be thought,” and that it is not simply a verbal formula.

Again, that you say that, when you hear it, you are not able to think or have in your mind “that than which a greater cannot be thought” on the basis of something known from its species or genus, so that you neither know the thing itself, nor can you form an idea of it from something similar. But quite evidently the matter is and remains otherwise [aliter sese habere]. For, every lesser good, insofar as it is good, is similar to a greater good. It is apparent to any reasonable mind that by ascending from lesser goods to greater ones, from those than which something greater can be thought, we are able to infer much [multum. . .conjicere] about that than which nothing greater can be thought. (S., p. 138)

Anselm notes a similarity between the terms “ineffable,” “unthinkable,” and “that than which nothing greater can be thought,” for in each case, it can be impossible for us to think or understand the thing referred to by the expression, but the expression can be thought and understood. Earlier on, Anselm makes a distinction that sheds additional light on this distinction between thinking and understanding the expression, and thinking and understanding the thing referred to by the expression. He also employs a useful metaphor. “[I]f you say that what is not entirely understood is not understood and is not in the understanding: say, then, that since someone is not able to gaze upon the purest light of the sun does not see light that is nothing but sunlight.” (S., p. 132) We do not have to fully and exhaustively understand what a term refers to in order for us to understand the term, and that applies to this case. “Certainly ‘that than which a greater cannot be thought’ is understood and is in the understanding at least to the extent [hactenus] that these things are understood of it.” (S., p. 132)

Anselm also clarifies the scope of his argument, indicating that it applies only to God: “I say confidently that if someone should find for me something existing either in reality or solely in thought, besides ‘that than which a greater cannot be thought,’ to which the schematic framework [conexionem] of my argument could rightly be adapted [aptare valeat], I will find and give him this lost island, nevermore to be lost.” (S., p. 134)

6. The Monologion

This earlier and considerably longer work includes an argument for God’s existence, but also much more discussion of the divine attributes and economy, and some discussion of the human mind. The proof Anselm provides in Chapter 1 is one he considers easiest for a person

who, either because of not hearing or because of not believing, does not know of the one nature, greatest of all things that are, alone sufficient to itself in its eternal beatitude, and who by his omnipotent goodness gives to and makes for all other things that they are something or that in some way they are well [aliquomodo bene sunt], and of the great many other things that we necessarily believe about God or about what he has created. (S., v. 1, p. 13)

The Monologion proof argues from the existence of many good things to a unity of goodness, a one thing through which all other things are good. Anselm first asks whether the diversity of good we experience through our senses and through our mind’s reasoning are all good through one single good thing, or whether there are different and multiple good things through which they are good. He recognizes, of course, that there are a variety of ways for things to be good things, and he also recognizes that many things are in fact good through other things. But, he is pushing the question further, since for every good thing B through which another good thing A is good, one can still ask what that good thing B is good through. If goods can even be comparable as goods, there must be some more general and unified way of regarding their goodness, or that through which they are good. Anselm argues: “you are not accustomed to considering something good except on an account of some usefulness, as health and those things that conduce to health are said to be good [propter aliquam utilitatem], or because of being of intrinsic value in some way [propter quamlibet honestatem], just as beauty and things that contribute to beauty are esteemed to be a good.” (S., p. 14)

This being granted, usefulness and intrinsic values can be brought to a more general unity. “It is necessary, for all useful or intrinsically valuable things, if they are indeed good things, that they are good through this very thing, through which all goods altogether [cuncta bona] must exist, whatever this thing might be.” (S., p. 14-5) This good alone is good through itself. All other good things are ultimately good through this thing, which is the superlative or supreme good. Certain corollaries can be drawn from this. One is that all good things are not only good through this Supreme Good; they are good, that is to say they have their being from the Supreme Good. Another is that “what is supremely good [summe bonum] is also supremely great [summe magnum]. Accordingly, there is one thing that is supremely good and supremely great, i.e. the highest [summum] of all things that are.” (S., p. 15) In Chapter 2, Anselm clarifies what he means by “great,” making a point that will assume greater importance in Chapter 15: “But, I am speaking about ‘great’ not with respect to physical space [spatio], as if it is some body, but rather about things that are greater [maius] to the degree that they are better [melius] or more worthy [dignus], for instance wisdom.” (S., p. 15)

Chapter 3 provides further discussion of the ontological dependence of all beings on this being. For any thing that is or exists, there must be something through which it is or exists. “For, everything that is, either is through [per] something or through nothing. But nothing is through nothing. For, it cannot be thought [non. . .cogitari potest] that something should be but not through something. So, whatever is, only is through something.” (S., p. 15-6) Anselm considers and rejects several possible ways of explaining how it is that all things are. There could be one single being through which all things have their being. Or there could be a plurality of beings through which other beings have their being. The second possibility allows three cases: “[I]f they are multiple, then either: 1) they are referred to some single thing through which they are, or 2) they are, individually [singula], through themselves [per se], or 3) they are mutually through each other [per se invicem].” (S., p. 16)

In the first case, they are all through one single being. In the second case, there is still some single power or nature of existing through oneself [existendi per se], common to all of them. Saying that they exist through themselves really means that they exist through this power or nature which they share. Again, they have one single ontological ground upon which they are dependent. One can propose the third case, but it is upon closer consideration absurd. “Reason does not allow that there would be many things [that have their being] mutually through each other, since it is an irrational thought that some thing should be through another thing, to which the first thing gives its being.” (S., p. 16)

For Anselm three things follow from this. First, there is a single being through which all other beings have their being. Second, this being must have its being through itself. Third, in the gradations of being, this being is to the greatest degree.

Whatever is through something else is less than that through which everything else together is, and that which alone is through itself. . . . So, there is one thing that alone, of all things, is, to the greatest degree and supremely [maxime et summe]. For, what of all things is to the greatest degree, and through which anything else is good or great, and through which anything else is something, necessarily that thing is supremely good and supremely great and the highest of all things that are. (S., p. 16)

Chapter 4 continues this discussion of degrees. In the nature of things, there are varying degrees (gradus) of dignity or worth (dignitas). The example Anselm uses is humorous and indicates an important feature of the human rational mind, namely its capacity to grasp these different degrees of worth. “For, one who doubts whether a horse in its nature is better than a piece of wood, and that a human being is superior to a horse, that person assuredly does not deserve to be called a human being.” (S., p. 17) Anselm argues that there must be a highest nature, or rather a nature that does not have a superior, otherwise the gradations would be infinite and unbounded, which he considers absurd. By argumentation similar to that of the previous chapters, he adduces that there can only be one such highest nature. The scale of gradations comes up again later in Chapter 31, where he indicates that creatures’ degrees of being, and being superior to other creatures, depends on their degree of likeness to God (specifically to the divine Word).

[E]very understanding judges natures in any way living to be superior to non-living ones, sentient natures to be superior to non-sentient ones, rational ones to be superior to irrational ones. For since the Supreme Nature, in its own unique manner, not only is but also lives and perceives and is rational, it is clear that. . . what in any way is living is more alike to the Supreme Nature than that which does not in any way live; and, what in any way, even by bodily sense, knows something is more like the Supreme Nature than what does not perceive at all; and, what is rational is more like the Supreme Nature than what is not capable of reason. (S., p. 49)

Through something akin to what analytic philosophers might term a thought-experiment and phenomenologists an eidetic variation, Anselm considers a being gradually stripped of reason, sentience, life, and then the “bare being” (nudum esse) that would be left: “[T]his substance would be in this way bit by bit destroyed, led by degrees (gradatim) to less and less being, and finally to non-being. And, those things that, when they are taken away [absumpta] one by one from some essence, reduce it to less and less being, when they are reassumed [assumpta] . . . lead it to greater and greater being.” (S., p. 49-50)

In the chapters that follow, Anselm indicates that the Supreme Nature derives its existence only from itself, meaning that it was never brought into existence by something else. Anselm uses an analogy to suggest how the being of the Supreme Being can be understood.

Therefore in what way it should be understood [intelligenda est] to be through itself and from itself [per se et ex se], if it does not make itself, not arise as its own matter, nor in any way help itself to be what it was not before?. . . .In the way “light” [lux] and “to light” [lucere] and “lighting” [lucens] are related to each other [sese habent ad invicem], so are “essence” [essentia] and “to be” [esse] and “being,” i.e. supremely existing or supremely subsisting. (S., p. 20)

This Supreme Nature is that through which all things have their being precisely because it is the Creator, which creates all beings (including the matter of created beings) ex nihilo.

In Chapters 8-14, the argument shifts direction, leading ultimately to a restatement of the traditional Christian doctrine of the Logos (the “Word” of God, the Son of the Father and Creator). The argumentation starts by examination of the meaning of “nothing,” distinguishing different senses and uses of the term. Creation ex nihilo could be interpreted three different ways. According to the first way, “what is said to have been made from nothing has not been made at all.” (S., p. 23) In another way, “something was said to be made from nothing in this way, that it was made from this very nothing, that is from that which is not; as if this nothing were something existing, from which something could be made.” (S., p. 23) Finally, there is a “third interpretation. . . when we understand something to be made but that there is not something from which it has been made.” (S., p. 23)

The first way, Anselm says, cannot be properly applied to anything that actually has been made, and the second way is simply false, so the third way or sense is the correct interpretation. In Chapter 9, an important implication of creation ex nihilo is drawn out “There is no way that something could come to be rationally from another, unless something preceded the thing to be made in the maker’s reason as a model, or to put it better a form, or a likeness, or a rule.” (S., p. 24) This, in turn implies another important doctrine: “what things were going to be, or what kinds of things or how the things would be, were in the supreme nature’s reason before everything came to be.” (S., p. 24) In subsequent chapters, the doctrine is further elaborated, culminating in this pattern being the utterance (locutio) of the supreme essence and the supreme essence, that is to say the Word (verbum) of the Father, while being of the same substance as the Father.

Chapter 15-28 examine, discuss, and argue for particular attributes of God, 15-17 and 28 being of particular interest. Chapter 15 is devoted to the matter of what can be said about the divine substance. Relative terms do not really communicate the essence of the divine being, even including expressions such as “the highest of all” (summa omnium) or “greater than everything that has been created by it” (maior omnibus . . .) “For if none of those things ever existed, in relation to which [God] is called “the highest” and “greater,” it would be understood to be neither the highest nor greater. But still, it would be no less good on that account, nor would it suffer any loss of the greatness of its essence. And this is obvious, for this reason: whatever may be good or great, this thing is not such through another but by its very self.” (S., p. 28)

There are still other ways of talking about the divine substance. One way is to say that the divine substance is “whatever is in general [omnino] better that what is not it. For, it alone is that than which nothing is better, and that which is better than everything else that is not what it is.” (S., p. 29) Given that explanation, while there are some things that it is better for certain beings to be rather than not to be, God will not be those things, but only what it is absolutely better to be than not to be. So, for instance, God will not be a body, but God will be wise or just. Anselm provides a partial listing of the qualities or attributes that do express the divine essence: “living, wise, powerful and all-powerful, true, just, happy, eternal, and whatever in like wise it is absolutely better to be than not to be.” (S., p. 29)

Anselm raises a problem in Chapter 16. Granted that God has these attributes, one might think that all that is being signified is that God is a being that has these attributes to a greater degree than other beings, not what God is. Anselm uses justice as the example, which is fitting since it is usually conceived of as something relational. Anselm first sets out the problem in terms of participation in qualities. “[E]verything that is just is just through justice, and similarly for other things of this sort. Accordingly, that very supreme nature is not just unless through justice. So, it appears that by participation in the quality, namely justice, the supremely good substance can be called just.” (S., p. 30) And this reasoning leads to the conclusion that the supremely good substance “is just through another, and not through itself.” (S., p. 30)

The problem is that God is what he is through himself, while other things are what they are through him. In the case of each divine attribute, as in the later Proslogion, God having that attribute is precisely that attribute itself, so that for instance, God is not just by some standard or idea of justice extrinsic to God himself, but rather God is God’s own justice, and justice in the superlative sense. Everything else canhave the attribute of justice, whereas God is justice. This argument can be extended to all of God’s attributes What is perceived to have been settled in the case of justice, the intellect is constrained by reason to judge [sentire] to be the case about everything that is said in a similar way about that supreme nature. Whichever of them, then, is said about the supreme nature, it is not how [qualis] nor how much [quanta] [the supreme nature has quality] that is shown [monstratur] but rather what it is. . . .Thus, it is the supreme essence, supreme life, supreme reason, supreme salvation [salus], supreme justice, supreme wisdom, supreme truth, supreme goodness, supreme greatness, supreme beauty, supreme immortality, supreme incorruptibility, supreme immutability, supreme happiness, supreme eternity, supreme power [potestas], supreme unity, which is nothing other than supreme being, supremely living, and other things in like wise [similiter]. (S., p. 30-1)

This immediately raises yet another problem, however, because this seems like a multiplicity of supreme attributes, implying that each is a particularly superlative way of being for God, suggesting that God is in some manner a composite. Instead, in God (not in any other being) each of these is all of the others. God’s being alone, as Chapter 28 argues, is being in an unqualified sense. All other beings, since they are mutable, or because they can be understood to have come from non-being, “barely (vix) exist or almost (fere) do not exist.” (S., p. 46)

Chapters 29-48 continue the investigation of the generation of the “utterance” or Word, the Son, from the Father in the divine economy, and 49-63 expand this to discussion of the love between the Father and the Son, namely the Holy Spirit, equally God as the Father and Son. 64-80 discuss the human creature’s grasp and understanding of God. Chapter 31 is of particular interest, and discusses the relationship between words or thoughts in human minds and the Word or Son by which all things were created by the Father. A human mind contains images or likenesses of things that are thought of or talked about, and a likeness is true to the degree that it imitates more or less the thing of which it is likeness, so that the thing has a priority in truth and in being over the human subject apprehending it, or more properly speaking, over the image, idea, or likeness by which the human subject apprehends the thing. In the Word, however, there are not likenesses or images of the created things, but instead, the created things are themselves imitations of their true essences in the Word.

The discussion in Chapters 64-80, which concludes the Monologion, makes three central points. First, the triune God is ineffable, and except in certain respects incomprehensible, but we can arrive at this conclusion and understand it to some degree through reason. This is because our arguments and investigations do not attain the distinctive character (proprietatem) of God. That does not present an insurmountable problem, however.

For often we talk about many things that we do not express properly, exactly as they really are, but we signify through another thing what we will not or can not bring forth properly, as for instance when we speak in riddles. And often we see something, not properly, exactly how the thing is, but through some likeness or image, for instance when we look upon somebody’s face in a mirror. Indeed, in this way we talk about and do not talk about, see and do not see, the same thing. We talk about it and see it through something else; we do not talk about it and see it through its distinctive character [proprietatem]Now, whatever names seem to be able to be said of this nature, they do not so much reveal it to me through its distinctive character as signify it [innuunt] to me through some likeness. (S., v. 1, p. 76)

Anselm uses the example of the divine attribute of wisdom. “For the name ‘wisdom’ is not sufficient to reveal to me that being through which all things were made from nothing and preserved from [falling into] nothing.” (S., p. 76)

The outcome of this is that all human thought and knowledge about God is mediated through something. Likenesses are never the thing of which they are a likeness, but there are greater and lesser degrees of likeness. This leads to the second point. Human beings come closer to knowing God through investigating what is closer to him, namely the rational mind, which is a mirror both of itself and, albeit in a diminished way, of God.

[J]ust as the rational mind alone among all other creatures is able to rise to the investigation of this Being, likewise it is no less alone that through which the rational mind itself can make progress towards investigation of that Being. For we have already come to know [jam cognitum est] that the rational mind, through the likeness of natural essence, most approaches that Being. What then is more evident than that the more assiduously the rational mind directs itself to learning about itself, the more effectively it ascends to the knowledge [cognitionem] of that Being, and that the more carelessly it looks upon itself, the more it descends from the exploration [speculatione] of that Being? (S., v. 1, p. 77)

Third, to be truly rational involves loving and seeking God, which in fact requires an effort to remember and understand God. “[I]t is clear that the rational creature ought to expend all of its capacity and willing [suum posse et velle] on remembering and understanding and loving the Supreme Good, for which purpose it knows itself to have its own being.” (S., p. 79)

7. Cur Deus Homo

The Monologion and Proslogion (although often only Chapters 2-4 of the latter) are typically studied by philosophers. The Cur Deus Homo (Why God Became Man) is more frequently studied by theologians, particularly since Anselm’s interpretation of the Atonement has been influential in Christian theology. The method, however, as in his other works, is primarily a philosophical one, attempting to understand truths of the Christian faith through the use of reasoning, granted of course, that this reasoning is applied to theological concepts. Anselm provides a twofold justification for the treatise, both responding to requests “by speech and by letter.” The first is for those asking Anselm to discuss the Incarnation, providing rational accounts (rationes) “not so that through reason they attain to faith, but so that they may delight in the understanding and contemplation of those things they believe, and so that they might be, as much as possible, ‘always ready to satisfy all those asking with an account [rationem] for those things for which’ we ‘hope.’” (S., v. 2, p. 48)

The second is for those same people, but so that they can engage in argument with non-Christians. As Anselm says, non-believers make the question of the Incarnation a crux in their arguments against Christianity, “ridiculing Christian simplicity as foolishness, and many faithful are accustomed to turn it over in their hearts.” (S., p. 48) The question simply stated is this: “by what reason or necessity was God made man, and by his death, as we believe and confess, gave back life to the world, when he could have done this either through another person, either human or angelic, or through his will alone?” (S., p. 48)

In Chapter 3, Anselm’s interlocutor, his fellow monk and student Boso, raises several specific objections made by non-Christians to the Christian doctrine of the Incarnation: “we do injustice and show contempt [contumeliam] to God when we affirm that he descended into a woman’s womb, and that he was born of woman, that he grew nourished by milk and human food, and – so that I can pass over many other things that do not seem befitting to God– that he endured weariness, hunger, thirst, lashes, and the cross and death between thieves.” (S., v. 2, p. 51)

Anselm’s immediate response mirrors the structure of the Cur Deus Homo. Each of the points he makes are argued in fuller detail later in the work.

For it was fitting that, just as death entered into the human race by man’s disobedience, so should life be restored by man’s obedience. And, that, just as the sin that was the cause of our damnation had its beginning from woman, so the author of our justice and salvation should be born from woman. And, that the devil conquered man through persuading him to taste from the tree [ligni], should be conquered by man through the passion he endured on the tree [ligni]. (S., p. 51)

The first book (Chapters 1-25), produces a lengthy argument, involving a number of distinctions, discussions about the propriety of certain expressions and the entailments of willing certain things. Chapters 16-19 represent a lengthy digression involving questions about the number of angels who fell or rebelled against God, whether their number is to be made up of good humans, and related questions. The three most important parts of the argument take the form of these discussions: the justice and injustice of God, humans, and the devil; the entailments of the Father and the Son willing the redemption of humanity; the inability of humans to repay God for their sins.

Anselm distinguishes, as he does in the earlier treatise De Veritate, different ways in which an action or state can be just or unjust, specifically just and unjust at the same time, but not in the same way of looking at the matter. “For, it happens sometimes [contingit] that the same thing is just and unjust considered from different viewpoints [diversis considerationibus], and for this reason it is adjudged to be entirely just or entirely unjust by those who do not look at it carefully.” (S., p. 57) Humans are justly punished by God for sin, and they are justly tormented by the devil, but the devil unjustly torments humans, even though it is just for God to allow this to take place.“In this way, the devil is said to torment a man justly, because God justly permits this and the man justly suffers it. But, because a man is said to justly suffer, one does not mean that he justly suffers because of his own justice, but because he is punished by God’s just judgment.” (S., p. 57)

Not only distinguishing between different ways of looking at the same matter is needed, but also distinguishing between what is directly willed and what is entailed in willing certain things. On first glance, it could seem that God the Father directly wills the death of Jesus Christ, God the Son, or that the latter wills his own death. Indeed something like this has to be the case, because God does will the redemption of humanity, and this comes through the Incarnation and through Christ’s death and resurrection. According to Anselm, Christ dies as an entailment of what it is that God wills. “For, if we intend to do something, but propose to do something else first through which the other thing will be done, when what we chose to be first is done, if what we intend comes to be, it is correctly said to be done on account of the other…” (S., p. 62-3) Accordingly, what God willed (as both Father and Son) was the redemption of the human race, which required the death of Christ, and required this “not because the Father preferred the death of the Son over his life, but because the Father was not willing to restore the human race unless man did something as great as that death of Christ was.” (S., p. 63) As Anselm goes on to explain, the determination of the Son’s will then takes place within the structure of the Father’s will. “Since reason did not demand that another person do what he could not, for that reason the Son says that he wills his own death, which he preferred to suffer rather than that the human race not be saved.” (S., p. 63-4) What was involved in Christ’s death, therefore, was actually obedience on the part of the Son, following out precisely what was entailed by God’s willing to redeem humanity. The central point of the argument is then making clear why the redemption of humanity would have to involve the death of Christ. Articulating this, Anselm begins by discussing sin in terms of what is due or owed to (quod debet) God.

Sin is precisely not giving God what is due to him, namely: “[e]very willing [voluntas] of a rational creature should [debet] be subject to God’s will.” (S., p. 68) Doing this is justice or rightness of will, and is the “sole and complete debt of honor” (solus et totus honor), which is owed to God. Now, sin, understood as disobedience and contempt or dishonor, is not as simple, nor as simple to remedy, as it first appears. In the sinful act or volition, which already requires its own compensation, there is an added sin against God’s honor, which requires additional compensation. “But, so long as he does not pay for [solvit] what he has wrongly taken [rapuit], he remains in fault. Nor does it suffice simply to give back what was taken away, but for the contempt shown [pro contumelia illata] he ought to give back more than he took away.” (S., p. 68)

Anselm provides analogous examples: one endangering another’s safety ought to restore the safety, but also compensate for the anguish (illata doloris iniuria recompenset); violating somebody’s honor requires not only honoring the person again, but also making recompense in some other way; unjust gains should be recompensed not only by returning the unjust gain, but also by something that could not have otherwise been demanded.

The question then is whether it would be right for God to simply forgive humans sins out of mercy (misericordia), and the answer is that this would be unbefitting to God, precisely because it would contravene justice. It is really impossible, however, for humans to make recompense or satisfaction, that is to say, satisfy the demands of justice, for their sins. One reason for this is that one already owes whatever one would give God at any given moment. Boso suggests numerous possible recompenses: “[p]enitence, a contrite and humbled heart, abstinence and bodily labors of many kinds, and mercy in giving and forgiving, and obedience.” (S., p. 68)

Anselm responds, however: “When you give to God something that you owe him, even if you do not sin, you ought not reckon this as the debt that you own him for sin. For, you owe all of these things you mention to God.” (S., p. 68) Strict justice requires that a human being make satisfaction for sin, satisfaction that is humanly impossible. Absent this satisfaction, God forgiving the sin would violate strict justice, in the process contravening the supreme justice that is God. A human being is doubly bound by the guilt of sin, and is therefore “inexcusable” having “freely [sponte] obligated himself by that debt that he cannot pay off, and by his fault cast himself down into this impotency, so that neither can he pay back what he owed before sinning, namely not sinning, nor can he pay back what he owes because he sinned.” (S., p. 92)

Accordingly, humans must be redeemed through Jesus Christ, who is both man and God, the argument for which comes in Book II, starting in Chapter 6, and elaborated through the remainder of the treatise, which also treats subsidiary problems. The argument at its core is that only a human being can make recompense for human sin against God, but this being impossible for any human being, such recompense could only be made by God. This is only possible for Jesus Christ, the Son, who is both God and man, with (following the Chalcedonian doctrine) two natures united but distinct in the same person (Chapter7). The atonement is brought about by Christ’s death, which is of infinite value, greater than all created being (Chapter 14), and even redeems the sins of those who killed Christ (Chapter 15). Ultimately, in Anselm’s interpretation of the atonement, divine justice and divine mercy in the fullest senses are shown to be entirely compatible.

8. De Grammatico

This dialogue stands on its own in the Anselmian corpus, and focuses on untangling some puzzles about language, qualities, and substances. Anselm’s solutions to the puzzles involve making needed distinctions at proper points, and making explicit what particular expressions are meant to express. The dialogue ends with the puzzles resolved, but also with Anselm signaling the provisional status of the conclusions reached in the course of investigation. He cautions the student: “Since I know how much the dialecticians in our times dispute about the question you brought forth, I do not want you to stick to the points we made so that you would hold them obstinately if someone were to be able to destroy them by more powerful arguments and set up others.” (S., v. 1, p.168)

The student begins by asking whether “expert in grammar” (grammaticus) is a substance or a quality. The question, and the discussion, has a wider scope, however, since once that is known, “I will recognize what I ought to think about other things that are similarly spoken of through derivation [denominative].” (S., p.144)

There is a puzzle about the term “expert in grammar,” and other like terms, because a case, or rather an argument, can be made for either option, meaning it can be construed to be a substance or a quality. The student brings forth the argument.

That every expert in grammar is a man, and that every man is a substance, suffice to prove that expert in grammar is a substance. For, whatever the expert in grammar has that substance would follow from, he has only from the fact that he is a man. So, once it is conceded that he is a man, whatever follows from being a man follows from being an expert in grammar. (S., v. 1, p.144-5)

At the same time, philosophers who have dealt with the subject have maintained that it is a quality, and their authority is not to be lightly disregarded. So, there is a serious and genuine problem. The term must signify either a substance or a quality, and cannot do both. One option must be true and the other false, but since there are arguments to be made for either side, it is difficult to tell which one is false.

The teacher responds by pointing out that the options are not necessarily incompatible with each other. Before explaining how this can be so, he asks the student to lay out the objections against both options. The student begins by attacking the premise “expert in grammar is a man” (grammaticum esse hominem) with two arguments

No expert in grammar can be understood [intelligi] without reference to grammar, and every man can be understood without reference to grammar.Every expert in grammar admits of [being] more and less, and No man admits of [being] more or less From either one of these linkings [contextione] of two propositions one conclusion follows, i.e. no expert in grammar is a man. (S., p.146)

The teacher states, however, that this conclusion does not follow from the premises, and uses a similar argument to illustrate his point. The term “animal” signifies “animate substance capable of perception,” which can be understood without reference to rationality. The teacher then gets the student to admit to a further proposition, “every animal can be understood without reference to rationality, and no animal is from necessity rational,” to which he adds: “But no man can be understood without reference to rationality, and it is necessary that every man be rational.” (S., p.147) The implication, which the student sees and would like to avoid, is the clearly false conclusion, “no man is an animal.” On the other hand, the student does not want to give up the connection between man and rationality.

The teacher indicates a way out of the predicament by noting that the false conclusions are arrived at by inferring from the premises in a mechanical way, without examining what is in fact being expressed by the premises, without making proper distinctions based on what is being expressed, and without restating the premises as propositions more adequately expressing what the premises are supposed to assert. The teacher begins by asking the student to make explicit what the man, and the expert in grammar, are being understood as with or without reference to grammar. This allows the premises in the student’s arguments to be more adequately restated.

Every man can be understood as man without reference to grammar. No expert in grammar can be understood as expert in grammar without reference to grammar.No man is more or less man, and Every expert in grammar is more or less an expert in grammar. (S., v. 1, p.148-9)

In both cases, it is now apparent that where it seemed previously there was a common term, and therefore a valid syllogism, there is in fact no common term. This does not mean that nothing can be validly inferred from them. But, in order for something to be validly inferred, a common term must be found. The teacher advises: “The common term of a syllogism should be not so much in the expression brought forward [in prolatione] as in meaning [in sententia].” (S., p.149) The reasoning behind this is that what “binds the syllogism together” is the meaning of the terms used, not the mere words, “For just as nothing is accomplished if the term is common in language [in voce] but not in meaning [in sensu], likewise nothing impedes us if it is in our understanding [in intellectu] but not in the expression brought forward [in prolatione].” (S., p.149)

The first set of premises of the of the student’s double argument can be reformulated then as the following new premises.

To be a man does not require grammar, and
To be an expert in grammar requires grammar. (S., p.149)

Thus restated, the premises do have a common term, and a conclusion can be inferred from them namely: “To be an expert in grammar is not to be a man, i.e., there is not the same definition for both of them.” (S., p.149) What this conclusion means is not that an expert in grammar is not a man, but rather that they are not identical, they do not have the same definition. Other syllogisms, appearing at first glance valid but terminating in false conclusions, can similarly be transformed. One that deals directly with the student’s initial question runs:

Every expert in grammar is spoken of as a quality [in eo quod quale].
No man is spoken of as a quality.
Thus, no man is an expert in grammar. (S., p.150)

The premises can be reformulated according to their meaning:

Every expert in grammar is spoken of as expert in grammar as a quality.
No man is spoken of as man as a quality. (S., p.150)

It is now apparent that again there is no middle term, and the conclusion does not validly follow. The student explores various possible syllogisms that might be constructed before the teacher indicates that the student, who ends with the conclusion, “the essence of man is not the essence of expert in grammar,” (S., p.150) has not fully grasped the lesson. The teacher brings in a further distinction, that of respect or manner (modo). This requires attention to what is actually being signified by the expressions “man,” and “expert in grammar.” An expert in grammar, who is a man, can be understood as a man without reference to grammar, so in some respect an expert in grammar can be understood without reference to grammar (that is, understood as man, not as an expert in grammar, which he nonetheless still is). And, a man, who is an expert in grammar, who is to be understood as an expert in grammar, cannot be so understood without reference to grammar.

Another puzzle can be raised about man and expert in grammar, bearing on being present in a subject. An argument clearly going against Aristotle’s intentions can be derived by using one of his statements as a premise.

Expert in grammar is among those things that are in a subject.
And, no man is in a subject.
So, no expert in grammar is a man. (S., p.154)

The teacher again directs the student to pay close attention to the meaning of what is being said. When one speaks about an “expert in grammar,” the things that are signified are “man” and “grammar.” Man is a substance, and is not present in a subject, but grammar is a quality and is present in a subject. So, depending on what way one looks at it, someone can say that expert in grammar is a substance and is not in a subject, if they mean “expert in grammar” insofar as the expert in grammar is a man (secundum hominem). Alternately, one can say that expert in grammar is a quality and is in a subject, if they mean “expert in grammar” with respect to grammar (secundum grammaticam). Similarly, “expert in grammar” can be regarded, from different points of view, as being primary or secondary substance, or as neither.

“Expert in grammar” has been shown to be able to be both a substance and a quality, so that there is no inconsistency between them. The student then raises a related problem, asking why “man” cannot similarly be a substance and a quality. “For man signifies a substance along with all those differentia that are in man, such as sensibility and mortality.” (S., p.156) The teacher points out that the case of “man” is not similar to that of “expert in grammar.” “[Y]ou do not consider how dissimilarly the name ‘man’ signifies those things of which a man consists, and how expert in grammar [signifies] man and grammar. Truly, the name ‘man’ signifies by itself and as one thing those things of which the entire man consists.” (S., p.156)

“Expert in grammar,” however, signifies “man” and “grammar” in different ways. It signifies “grammar” by itself (per se); it signifies “man” by something else (per aliud). Expertise in grammar is an accident of man, so “expert in grammar” cannot signify “man” in any unconditioned sense, but rather is something said of man (appellative hominis). The man is the underlying substance in which there can be grammar, and the underlying substance can be expert in grammar.

So, “expert in grammar” can rightly be understood in accordance with Aristotle’s Categories as a quality, because it signifies a quality. At the same time, “expert in grammar” is said of a substance, that is to say, man. This still raises some problems in the mind of the student, who suggests “expert in grammar” could be a having, or under the category of having, and asks whether a single thing can be of several categories. The teacher, conceding that the issue requires further study, maintains, directing the student through several examples, that a single expression that signifies more than one thing can be in more than one category, provided the things that are signified are not signified as actually one thing.

9. The De Veritate

This dialogue, which Anselm describes in its preface as one of “three treatises pertaining to the study of Sacred Scripture,” dealing with “what truth is, in what things [quibus rebus] truth is customarily said to be, and what justice is” (S., v. 1, p. 173), begins with a student asking for a definition of truth. The dialogical lesson takes the truth of statements as a starting point. A statement is true “[w]hen what it states [quod enuntiat], whether in affirming or in negating, is so [est].” (S., v. 1, p. 177) Given this, Anselm’s theory of truth appears at first glance a simple correspondence theory, where truth consists in the correspondence between statements and states of affairs signified by those statements.

His theory is more complex, however, and relies on a Platonic notion of participation, or more accurately stated, weds together a correspondence theory with a Platonic participational view. “[N]othing is true except by participating in truth; and so the truth of the true thing is in the true thing itself. But truly the thing stated is not in the true statement. So, it [the thing stated] should not be called its truth, but the cause of its truth. For this reason it seems to me that the truth of the statement should be sought only in the language itself [ipsa oratione].” (S., v. 1, p. 177) It is very important at this point to keep in mind that Anselm is not saying that all truth is simply in language, but rather that the truth of statements, truth of signification, lies in the language used. The truth of the statement cannot be the statement itself, nor can it be the statement’s signifying, nor the statement’s “definition,” for in any of these cases, the statement would always be true. Instead, statements are true when they signify correctly or rightly, and Anselm provides the key term for his larger theory of truth, “rectitude” or “rightness.” “Therefore its [an affirmation’s] truth is not something different than rightness [rectitudo].” (S., p. 178)

Anselm notes, however, that even when a statement affirms that what-is-not is, or vice versa, there is stillsome truth or correctness to the statement. This is so because there are two kinds of truth in signifying, for a statement can signify that what is the case is the case, and it does signify what it signifies. “There is one rightness and truth of the statement because it signifies what it was made to signify [ad quod significandum facta est]; and, there is another, when it signifies that which it received the capacity to signify [quod accepit significare].” (S., p. 179)

Accordingly, for Anselm, the truth of statements consists in part in the correspondence of the statement to the state of affairs signified, but also in the signification itself, the sense or meaning of the statement. “It always possesses the latter kind of truth, but does not always possess the former. For, it has the latter kind naturally, but the former kind accidentally and according to usage.” (S., p.179) For example, the expression “it is day” always possesses the second kind of truth, since the expression can always signify what it does signify; in other words, it can convey a meaning. But, whether or not it possesses the first kind of truth depends on whether in fact it is day. According to Anselm, in certain statements, the two kinds of truth or correctness are inseparable from each other, examples of these being universal statements, such as “man is an animal.”

He goes on to discuss truth of other kinds, in thought, in the will, in action, in the senses, and in the being of things. Truth in thought is analogous to truth in signification, but Anselm discusses only the first kind of truth, where thoughts correspond to actual states of affairs, this being “rightness” of thought. Truth in the will likewise consists in rightness, in other words, willing what it is that one ought to will. With respect to actions, again truth is rightness, in this case goodness. “To do good [bene facere] and to do evil [male facere] are contraries. For this reason, if to do the truth [veritatem facere] and to do good are the same in opposition, they are not different in their signification. . . . [T]o do what is right [rectitudinem facere] is to do the truth… Nothing is more apparent then than that the truth of an action is its rightness.” (S., p. 182)

But Anselm distinguishes between natural actions, such as a fire heating, which are non-rational and necessary, and non-natural actions, such as giving alms, which are rational and non-necessary. The natural type is always true, like the second kind of truth in signification. The non-natural type is sometimes true, sometimes false, like the first kind of truth in signification. Truth of the senses, Anselm argues, is a misnomer, as the truth or falsity involving the senses is not in the senses but in the “judgment” (in opinione). “The inner sense itself makes an error [se fallit], rather than the exterior sense lying to it.” (S., p. 183)

Speaking of the second kind of truth in signification, and of the truth of natural actions involves reference to a “Supreme Truth,” namely, God. Everything that is, insofar as it is receives its being [quod est] from the Supreme Truth. An argument, placed in the mouth of the dialogue’s teacher, follows from this: 1) “If all things are this, i.e. what they are there [in the Supreme Truth], without a doubt they are what they ought to be.” 2) “But whatever is what it ought to be is rightly [recte est]. “Thus, everything that is, is rightly.” (S, p. 185)

This, however, seems to present a genuine and serious problem, given the existence and experience of evil, specifically, “many deeds done evilly” (multa opera male), in the world as we know it. In order to address this, Anselm resorts to the traditional distinction between God causing and God permitting evil. Evil actions and evil willing ought not to be, but what happens when God permits it, because He permits it, ought to be. The solution to this puzzle lies in further distinction. “For in many ways the same matter [eadem res] supports opposites when considered from different perspectives [diversis considerationibus]. This often happens to be the case for an action. . . .” (S., p. 187)

Anselm uses the example of a “beating” (percussio), which can be regarded both as an action, on the part of the agent, and as a passion, on the part of the passive sufferer. Both the active and the passive are necessarily connected. “For a beating is of the one acting and of the one suffering, whence it can be said of either the action [giving a beating] and the passion [getting a beating].” (S., p. 187) While these two are necessarily connected, the same is not true of the judgments that can be made regarding each side of the action, for instance the rightness of the action or the suffering. A person might be rightly beaten, but it may be wrong for this or that person to give the beating. The implication of this is that “it can happen that according to nature an action or a passion should be, but in respect to the person acting or the person suffering should not be, since neither should the former do it nor the latter suffer it.” (S., p. 188) In this case, and other similar cases, it is possible for the same thing to have seemingly contradictory determinations. The key here, however, is that the same thing is being “considered from different perspectives [diversis considerationibus]” (S., p. 188)

Anselm then brings all of the other kinds of truth back to the truth of signification, not reducing them all to signification, but rather indicating how they are connected to each other. “For, there is true or false signification not only in those things we are accustomed to call signs but also in all of the other things that we have spoken of. For, since something should not be done by someone unless it is something that someone should do, by the very fact that someone does something, he says and he signifies that he ought to do that thing.” (S., p. 189) In every action, according to this doctrine, there is an implicit assertion of truth being made (rightly or wrongly) by the agent. For example, an expert tells a non-expert that certain herbs are non-poisonous, but avoids eating them, his action’s (true) signification being more trustworthy than his (false) signification in his statement. This applies even further.

So likewise, if you did not know that one ought not to lie and somebody lied in your presence, then even if he were to tell you that he himself ought not to lie, he would himself tell you more by his deed [opere] that he ought to lie than by his words that he ought not [to lie]. Similarly, when somebody thinks of or wills something, if you did not know whether he ought to will or think of that thing, and if you could see his willing or his thought, he would signify to you by that very action [ipso opere] that he ought to think about and will that thing. And, if he did ought to do so, he would speak the truth. But if not, he would lie. (S., p. 189)

In Anselm’s parlance, it is possible for action, willing, and thinking to be false, in other words, to be lies on the part of the acting, willing, or thinking subject. This involves a reference, noted earlier, to the Supreme Truth, God, more specifically to the truth of the being of things as they are in the Supreme Truth. All of the types of truth or rightness are ultimately determined or conditioned by the Supreme Truth, which is “the cause of all other truths and rightnesses.” Some of these other truths are themselves in turn causes as well as effects, while others are simply effects. “Since the truth that is in the existence of things is an effect of the Supreme Truth, this is also the cause of the truth belonging to thoughts and the truth that is in propositions; but these two truths are not the cause of any truth.” (S., p. 189)

After having carried out these dialogic investigations of the various kinds of truth, Anselm is now ready to provide a definition: “Accordingly, unless I am mistaken, we can establish the definition that [definire quia] truth is rightness perceptible only to the mind.” (S., p. 191) This introduces the final discussion of the dialogue, the student asking: “But since you have taught me that all truth is rightness, and since rightness seems to me to be the same thing as justice, teach me also what I might understand justice to be.” (S., p. 191) The teacher’s first response is that justice, truth, and rightness are convertible with each other. “[W]hen we are speaking of rightness perceptible only to the mind, truth and rightness and justice are mutually defined in relation to each other [invicem sese definiunt].” (S., p. 192) This relationship allows the rational investigating human being to use one of these terms, or rather their understanding of the meaning of the terms, to arrive at understanding of the others (which is in fact what is going on in the dialogue itself) “[I]f somebody knows one of them and does not know the others, he can extend his knowledge [scientiam pertingere] though the known to the unknown. Verily, whoever knows one cannot not know the other two.” (S., p. 192)

Justice, however, has a sense more specific and appropriate to humans, “the justice to which praise is owed, just as to its contrary, namely injustice, condemnation is owed.” (S., p. 192) This sort of justice, Anselm argues, resides only in beings that know rightness, and therefore can will it. Accordingly, this kind of justice is present only in rational beings, and in human beings, it is not in knowledge or action but in the will. Justice is then defined as “rightness of will,” and as this could allow instances where one wills rightly, in other words what he or she ought to will, without wanting to be in such a situation, or instances where one does so want, but wills the right object for a bad motive, the definition of justice is further specified as “rightness of will kept for its own sake” (propter se servata). Anselm makes clear that this uprightness is received from God prior to the human being having it, willing it, or keeping it. And, it is in a certain way radically dependent on God’s own justice. “If we say that [God’s] uprightness is kept for its own sake, we do not seem to be able to suitably [conuenienter] speak likewise about any other rightness. For just as [God’s uprightness] itself and not some other thing, preserves itself, it is not through another but through itself, and likewise not on account of another thing but on account of itself.” (S., p. 196)

This leads to the final topic of the De Veritate, the unity of truth. According to Anselm, although there is a multiplicity of true things, and multiple and different ways for things to be truth, there is ultimately only one truth, prior to all of these, and in which they participate. From the discussions in earlier treatises, it is clear that this single and ultimate truth is, of course, God.

10. The De Libertate Arbitrii

This treatise is the second of the three treatises pertaining to the study of Sacred Scripture, and it deals primarily with the nature of the human will and its relation to the justice or rightness of will discussed at the end of the De Veritate. The student begins by asking the central questions:

Since free choice [liberum arbitrium] seems to be opposed to God’s grace, and predestination, and foreknowledge, I desire to know what this free choice is and whether we always have it. For if free choice is “to be able to sin and not sin,” just as it is customarily said by some people, and we always have it, in what way can we be in need of any grace? For if we do not always have it, why is sin imputed to us when we would sin without free choice. (S., v. 1, p. 207)

The immediate response is the denial that freedom of choice is or includes the ability to sin, for this would mean that God and the good angels, who cannot sin, would not have free choice. Anselm is unwilling even to entirely distinguish free choice of God and good angels from that of humans. “Although the free choice of humans differs from the free choice of God and the good angels, still the definition of this freedom, in accordance with this name, ought to be the same in either case.” (S., p. 208)

It appears at first that a will which can turn towards sinning or not sinning is more free, but this is to be able to lose what befits and what is useful or advantageous for (quod decet et quod expedit) the one willing. To be able to sin is actually an ability to become more unfree. Key to the argument is that not sinning is understood as a positive condition of maintaining uprightness or righteousness (rectitudo). Anselm makes two key points in support of this. “The will that cannot turn away from the righteousness of not sinning is thereby freer than one that can desert it [righteousness].” (S., p. 208) The analysis of the conceptions of freedom, sin, and power are similar to those in Proslogion Chapter 7: “The ability to sin, therefore, which when added to the will decreases its freedom and when taken away increases it, is neither freedom nor a part of freedom.” (S., v. 1, p. 209)

This raises two problems, however. Both the fallen angels and the first human were able to sin and did sin. Given the argument just made, being able to sin and freedom seem foreign (aliena) to each other, but if one does not sin from free choice, it seems one must sin of necessity. In addition, the notion of being a “servant of sin” requires clarification, specifically explaining how a free being can be mastered by sin, and thereby become a servant. Anselm makes a subtle distinction. In the case of the first man or the fallen angel, the Devil:

He sinned by his choice which was free, but not through that from which [unde] it was free, i.e. by the ability through which he was able to [per potestatem qua poterat] not sin and to not serve sin, but rather by the ability of sinning that he had [per potestatem quam habebat peccandi], by which he was neither aided toward the freedom of not sinning nor compelled to the service of sinning. (S., v. 1, p. 210)

Analogously to this, if somebody is able to be the servant of sin, this does not mean that sin is able to master him, so that his choice to sin, to become a servant of sin, is not free. Another question arises then, how a person, after becoming a servant of sin, would still be free, to which the answer is that one still retains some natural freedom of choice, but is unable to use one’s freedom of choice in exactly the same way as one could prior to choosing to sin. (Later in Chapter 12, Anselm clarifies that being a “servant of sin” is precisely “an inability to avoid sinning.”)

The difference, however, is all important. The freedom of choice which they originally possessed was oriented towards an end, that of “willing what they ought to will and what is advantageous for them to will,” (S., p. 211) in other words, uprightness or righteousness (rectitudo) of will. Anselm then considers four different possible ways in which they had this freedom oriented towards righteousness or uprightness of will:

whether for acquiring it without anyone giving it, since they did not yet have it
whether for receiving it when they did not yet have it, if someone were to give it to them so that they might have it
whether for deserting what they received and for recovering by themselves what they had deserted
whether for always keeping it once it was received (S., v. 1, p. 211)

The first three possibilities are rejected, leaving only the fourth. Rational creatures were originally given uprightness of will, which they were obliged to keep, but free (in one sense) to keep or lose. Freedom of choice, however, has a reason, namely, keeping this original uprightness-of-will for its own sake.

There are then two different possible states. So long as one keeps uprightness-of-will for its own sake, one does so freely. Once one loses uprightness-of-will through use of one’s free choice, one no longer has the ability to keep uprightness-of-will, really by definition, since one has after all lost it. Here, Anselm clarifies: “Even if uprightness of will is lacking, still [a] rational nature does not possess less than what belongs to it. For, as I view it, we have no ability that by itself suffices unto itself for its action; and still, when those things are lacking without which our abilities can hardly be brought to action, we still no less say that we have those abilities that are in us.” (S., p. 212-3)

He employs two analogies, one general, and one more specific. One can have an ability or an instrument that can accomplish something, but when the conditions for its employment are lacking, it cannot by itself bring anything about. Likewise, seeing a mountain requires not only sight, but also light and a mountain actually being there to be seen. When uprightness of will is lacking, having been lost, one still has theability to keep it, but the conditions for having and keeping it are lacking. “What prevents us from having the power of keeping uprightness of will for sake of that very uprightness, even if this very uprightness is absent, so long as within us there is reason, by which we are able to recognize it, and will, by which we are able to hold onto it? For the freedom of choice spoken of here consists in both of these [ex his enim constat].” (S., p. 214)

Chapters 5-9 discuss temptation, specifically how the will can be overcome by temptation, thereby turning away from or losing uprightness-of-will, by willing an action (for example, lying, murder, theft, adultery) contrary to God’s will. Anselm concedes that a person can be placed in a situation where options are constrained, and where unwelcome consequences follow from every option, for instance, when a person is constrained to choose between lying and thereby avoiding death (for a while), and dying. The will is stronger than any temptation, or even the Devil himself, but both temptation and the Devil can create difficulties for the resisting person, and can constrain the situations of choice. In these cases, the will can allow itself to be overcome. This still involves free choice of the will, but this is a free choice for one sort of unfreedom or another. Anselm argues that “a rational nature always possesses free choice, since it always possesses the ability of keeping uprightness of will for the sake of this rightness itself, even though with difficulty at some times.” (S., p. 222)

Once this uprightness has been lost, or rather abandoned freely, the free human being becomes a servant of sin because it cannot by itself regain that uprightness on its own. “Indeed, just as no will, before it possessed uprightness, was able to acquire it unless God gave it, so, after it deserted what it had received, it is not able to regain it unless God gives it back.” (S., p. 222) In such a condition, a human being remains free in the sense that they could keep uprightness-of-will, in other words, not sin, precisely by freely choosing to keep it, if they had it, which they do not. Once God gives it again, a human being is then once again free to keep it or to lose it. Freedom in the full sense for Anselm, therefore, consists in the ability to keep uprightness-of-will for its own sake, that is to say, choosing and acting in such a way as to keep oneself from losing it, even when faced with temptation.

11. The De Casu Diaboli

This dialogue, considerably longer than the preceding De Veritate and De Libertate, further develops certain themes they raised, and addresses several other philosophical issues of major importance, including the nature of evil and negation, and the complexities of the will. The dialogue begins in an attempt to understand the implications of all created beings having nothing that they have not received from God. “No creature has anything [aliud] from itself. For what does not even have itself from itself, in what way could it have anything from itself?” (S., v. 1, p. 233) Only God, the Creator, alone has anything (quidquid) from himself. All other beings, as dependent on God for their being, have what they have from him. The student raises an initial problem in Chapter 1, having to do with divine causation. It seems then that God is the cause not only of created beings having something, and for their being, but also that God is then the cause for their passing into non-being. This would then mean that God is the cause not only for whatever is, but also for whatever is not.

The teacher makes a needed distinction here. A thing is said to cause another thing to be in several different cases. One who actually causes something else to be is properly said to cause it. When one able to cause something not to be does not so cause it, and then the thing is (because the first thing does not interfere with the second thing being or coming to be), the first thing is improperly said to cause the second. Accordingly, God is said to cause things in both ways. God is also improperly said to cause what is not not to be, when what is actually meant by this is that God simply does not cause it to be. Likewise, when things pass from being to not-being, God does not cause this, even though he does not conserve them in being, because they simply return to their original state of non-being.

This has a bearing on the question of divine responsibility for evil, setting up the other problems of the dialogue.

Just as nothing that is not good comes from the Supreme Good, and every good is from the Supreme Good, likewise nothing that is not being [essentia] comes from the Supreme Being [essentia], and all being is from the Supreme Being. Since the Supreme Good is the Supreme Being, it follows that every being is a good thing and every good thing is a being. Therefore, just as nothing and non-being [non esse] are not being [essentia], likewise they are not good. So, nothing and non-being are not from He from whom nothing is unless it is good and being. (S., p. 235)

The central problem is that of understanding how the Devil could be responsible for his own sin, given that what he has he has from God, and the lengthy argumentation in Chapter 3 sets in clear light the problem’s complex nature. It seems that there is an inconsistency between God’s goodness and the justness of his judgment, on the one hand, and the Devil not receiving perseverance from God who did not give it to him, on the other hand. The student is making the global assumption, however, that since giving X is the cause of X being received, not giving X is the cause of X not being received.

In some cases this does not hold, however, and the teacher supplies an example. “If I offer [porrigo] you something, and you accept it [accipis], I do not therefore give it because you receive it [accipis], but you therefore receive it because I give it, and the giving is the cause of the receiving.” (S., p. 236) In that positive case, the giving is the cause of the receiving, but, if the case is made negative the order of causing what takes place (or rather what does not take place) is the opposite. “What if I offer that very thing to someone else and he does not accept it? Does he therefore not accept it because I do not give it?” The student realizes that the proper way of looking at matters is “rather that you do not give it because he does not accept it.” (S., p. 236) In cases like these, where not-giving X is not the cause of X not being received, if one does not give X, it can still be inferred that X is not received. This answer does not quell the student’s initial misgivings, however, for it simply pushes the fundamental problem back further. “If you wish to assert that God did not give to him because he did not receive, I ask: why did he not receive? Was it because he was not able to, or because he did not will to? For if he did not have the ability or the will to receive [potestatem aut uoluntatem accipiendi], God did not give it.” (S., p. 237) This seems to place the responsibility for the Devil’s lack back on God, and the student asks: “[I]f he was not able to have the ability or the will to receive perseverance unless God gives it, in what did he sin, by not accepting what God did not give him to be able or to will to receive [posse aut uelle accipere]?” (S., p. 237)

The answer is that God in fact did give this ability and will, and the student concludes that the Devil did receive perseverance from God. The teacher makes two important clarifications. The first is that “I did not say that God gave him the receiving of perseverance [accipere perseuerantiam], but rather to be able or to will to [posse aut uelle] receive perseverance.” (S., p. 237) The student then concludes that since the Devil willed to and was able to (voluit et potuit) receive perseverance, he did in fact receive it.

This leads to the second, much more involved clarification. There are cases where one is able to and wills to do something, but does not finish it or bring it about completely or perfectly, cases where one’s initial will is changed before the thing is entirely finished.

T: Then, you willed and you were able to persevere in what you did not persevere.
S: Certainly I willed to, but I did not persevere in willing [in voluntate], and so I did not persevere in the action.
T: Why did you not persevere in willing?
S: Because I did not will to.
T: But, so long as you willed to persevere in the action, you willed to persevere in that willing [in voluntate]? (S., p. 238)

The will is marked by a reflexivity, as the student recognizes when the teacher asks why he did not persevere in willing. One can answer that he did not persevere in willing (which is the reason he did not then continue to will) because he did not will to. This type of explanation could be iterated infinitely, and would not really explain anything thereby. Instead, the explanation for failure of will (defectus. . . uoluntatis) requires reference to something else, and this requires coining a new expression. As the teacher says: “Let us say. . . . that to persevere in willing is to ‘will completely’ [peruelle].”(S., p. 238) And, he asks his student: “When, therefore, you did not complete what you willed to and were able to, why did you not complete it?” In response, the student supplies the conclusion: “Because I did not will it completely.” (S., p. 238) This allows a partial resolution to the problem: even though the Devil received the will and the ability to receive perseverance and the will and the ability to persevere, he did not actually receive the perseverance because he did not will it completely. Again, this answer simply pushes the problem to yet another level, leading the student to ask:

Again I ask why he did not will completely. For when you say that what he willed he did not completely will, you are saying something like: What he willed at first, he did not will later. So, when he did not will what he willed before, why did he not will it unless because he did not have the will to? And by this latter I do not mean the will that he had previously when he willed it but the one that he did not have when he did not will it. But why did he not have this will, unless because he did not receive it? And, why did he not receive it, unless because God did not give it? (S., p. 239)

The teacher reminds the student of the point established earlier, that God did not give to the Devil because the Devil did not receive. Again the failure is on the side of the creature, and at this point, the teacher asserts that the Devil could have received keeping (tenere) what he had but instead abandoned or deserted it (deseruit). The relation between not-receiving and desertion has a parallel structure to not-giving and not-receiving: the Devil did not receive because he deserted, and God did not give to the Devilbecause the Devil did not receive.

Once again, this is only a partial solution, and it still seems that God could be responsible for the fall of the Devil, because God did not give something to the Devil, namely the will to keep, not to desert, what he had. The cause for someone deserting something, the student claims, is because that person does not will to keep it. The teacher’s response here is similar to the previous responses, since he distinguishes cases where the causal relation the student asserts to hold does not hold. It is dissimilar, however, and brings the complex argumentation of Chapter 3 to a close, because it introduces the key notion of conflicting objects of the will. Using the example of a miser who would will both to keep his money and to have bread, which requires him to spend money, the teacher notes that in this case, willing to desert is prior to not willing to keep some good, precisely because one wills to desert the thing in order to have something that one prefers to have. In the case of the Devil then:

the reason he did not will when he should have and what he should have was not that his will was deficient [defecit] because God failed [deo . . .deficiente] to give, but rather that the Devil himself, by willing what he should not have, expelled his good will because of an evil will arising. Accordingly, it was not because he did not have a good persevering will or he did not receive it, because God did not give it, but rather that God did not give it because the Devil, by willing what he should not have, deserted the good will, and by deserting it did not keep it. (S., p. 240)

In Chapters 4-28, issues raised by this solution to the problem are explored: the complex nature of the will, and the ontological status of evil, nothing, and injustice. Chapter 4 introduces a key distinction in objects of the will, between justice (justitia) and what is beneficial, useful, or agreeable (commodum). The case of the Devil is the case for rational, willing creatures generally. The teacher notes: “He could not have willed anything except for justice or what is beneficial. For, happiness, which all rational natures will, consists of beneficial things.” And, the student confirms this: “We can recognize this in ourselves, who will nothing except what we deem to be just or beneficial.” (S., p. 241)

The Devil went wrong by willing something beneficial, but which he did not have and was not supposed to have at the time he willed it; this was to will in a disordered manner (inordinate), and hereby to will the beneficial thing in such a way as to thereby not keep justice, precisely because willing the beneficial thing in a disordered way required abandoning justice. The Devil willed to be both like God and above God, by willing in such a way as to reject the order God introduced into things (including wills), or put in another way, using a term that somewhat resists translation: “he willed something by his very own will alone [propria voluntate], which was subject [subdita] to nobody. For it should be for God alone to so will something by his very own will alone, so that he does not follow a will superior [to his own].” (S., p. 242)

The will, in both angels and human beings, is complex, and can be regarded from different though complementary points of view, and in terms of its objects, which may differ or coincide. Chapters 12-14 discuss the relationships between the will, happiness, and justice. There are two fundamental kinds of good and two kinds of evil: justice (justitia) and what is beneficial, useful, or agreeable (commodum); injustice, and what is harmful or unpleasant (incommodum). Rational beings, as well as other beings that can perceive, have a natural will for avoiding what is harmful or unpleasant (incommodum) and for possessing what is beneficial, useful, or agreeable (commodum), and by this natural will, which is for happiness, they move themselves to willing other things, such as means by which to achieve the good they will.

In contrast, rational beings can be just or unjust, and can will justice or injustice. While all rational beings will happiness, not all of them will justice. It is possible for the two wills to conflict, and for one to will happiness inordinately, and in this way desert justice. Alternately, it is possible for one to will justice, which affects how happiness is willed.

Justice, when it is added, would so temper the will for happiness, that it would both curb the will’s excess and not cut off its ability of exceeding. So, because one would will to be happy, one could go to excess [excedere], but because one would will justly, one would not will to go to excess [excedere], and so having a just will for happiness one could and should be happy. And, by not willing what one ought not will, even though one could, one would merit being able to never will what should not be willed, and by always keeping justice through a restrained [moderatam] will, one would in no way be in need; but, if one were to desert justice through an unrestrained [immoderatam] will, one would be in need in every way. (S., p. 258)

Chapters 15-16 show that the relation between justice and injustice is one of a good and its privation, or put another way, justice is something, meaning it has goodness and it has being, while injustice is nothing but the absence or privation of the justice that should exist, namely in a will. The priority of justice over injustice means that the will retains traces (vestigia) of the justice it abandoned, namely that it ought to have justice. Injustice, or the state of being unjust, does not have any being, meaning it is nothing.

The relationships between evil, injustice, nothing, and the will are explained in Chapters 7-11, 19-20, and 26. First, as the teacher explains, the will itself, considered as will is not nothing. “Now, even if [the will, and the turning of the will] are not substances, still it cannot be proven that they are not beings [essentias], for there are many beings other than those which are properly called ‘substances.’ So then, a good will is not more something than an evil will is, nor is the latter more evil than the former is good.” (S., p. 245) The conclusion of this is not that the evil will is not in fact evil, but rather that “the evil will is not that very evil that makes evil people evil.” (S., p. 245)

The evil that makes people evil is instead injustice, the privation of justice, which is nothing. Saying that injustice and evil are in fact nothing raises a problem, however, for it does seem as if injustice and evil aresomething. For one, it seems that good and evil are both correlative to each other. “[E]vil is a privation of the good, I concede, but I see that good is no less the privation of evil. (S., p. 247) Posing a second difficulty, it seems that “evil” must signify something, since “evil” is a name. Lastly, the effects of evil seem in our experience to be something, so it seems paradoxical to insist that their cause is “nothing.”

These difficulties are resolved in several ways. First, as noted earlier, the relationship between evil or injustice as a privation, and its opposite, justice, is not a reciprocal one. Injustice is the privation of justice, justice is not the privation of injustice, but that which injustice is a privation of. Put another way, justice is something positive, and has being, and its being is not dependent upon or conditioned by its opposite and privation, injustice.

A second resolution lies in noting that “nothing” does signify, but signifies by negation. As the teacher says, making an important distinction:

“[E]vil” and “nothing” do signify something; still though what they signify is not evil or nothing. But, there is another way in which they signify something and what is signified is something; not truly something, though, but as-if something [quasi aliquid]. For indeed, many things are said in accordance with the form [of language] [secundum formam], which are not said in accordance with the reality [secundum rem]. (S., p. 250)So, in this way, “evil” and “nothing” signify something, and what is signified is something not in accordance with the reality but in accordance with the form of speaking. (S., p. 251)

A third resolution resides in explaining the relationship between the evil and nothing(ness) of injustice and the seeming positivity and being of things that get called evil. The will itself, as something, is good; in-itself, willing objects of the will, from the basest pleasures to being-like God, is good. Even the base and unclean useful or pleasurable things that irrational animals take pleasure in (commoda infima et immunda quibusirrationalia animalia delectantur, S., p. 257) are in themselves good. What allows some positive existing thing to be an evil is the disorder it is involved in, and this has to do with the will, and with injustice as such, which are the source of any positivity evil has. “[S]ince no thing is called “evil” except for an evil will or on account of an evil will – like an evil man and an evil action – nothing is clearer than that no thing is evil, nor is evil anything but the absence of the justice that has been deserted in the will, or in some thing because of an evil will.” (S., p. 264)The absence of justice in the will, or injustice, is always strictly speaking nothing, the absence or lack of what ought to be. However, “sometimes the evil that is harmful or unpleasant (incommodum) is clearly nothing, like blindness, other times it is something, like sadness or pain.” (S., p. 274) What we typically focus on in thinking about evil are the latter cases. “When, then, we hear the word ‘evil,’ we do not fear the evil that is nothing, but the evil that is something, which follows from the absence of the good. For, from injustice and blindness, which are evil and which are nothing, follow many harmful or unpleasant things (incommoda) that are evil and are something, and these are what we dread when we hear the word ‘evil.’” (S., p. 274)

Accordingly, returning to the original issue, what creatures have that is good, they have from God, and what they have of evil derives from them (or from other creatures), but ultimately from nothing, that is to say, from a lack of what ought to be (or of what ought to have been). In any given case, of course, for instance the Devil’s case, it may take considerable analysis to see how what God gave permitted evil to take place.

12. The De Concordia

This late work is of particular interest for several reasons. In its content, it deals with matters examined by Anselm’s previous works, developing his doctrines further. The De Concordia refers to earlier works by name, specifically De Veritate, De Libertate Arbitrii, De Casu Diaboli, and De Conceptu Virginali et de Originali Peccato. Stylistically, its form is intermediary between those of the treatises and those of the dialogues, for Anselm addresses the possible objections and responses of an interlocutor in the first book, but does so within one continuous discourse. By the second and third books, Anselm no longer addresses an interlocutor. The three main topics or “questions” of the title unevenly divide the books of the work.

The first question, or problem, is how free choice (liberum arbitrium) and God’s foreknowledge could be compatible. This is really a clash between freedom and necessity. “[I]t is necessary [necesse est] that those things that God foreknows be going to happen [esse futura], and those that come to be through free choice do not arrive through any necessity.” (S., v. 2, p. 245) Anselm’s procedure is to assume both free choice and God’s foreknowledge in order to see whether they do in fact contradict each other, reasoning that, if they are genuinely incompatible, some other impossibility will arise from them. The assumption does not in fact generate a contradiction.

[I]f something is going to happen without necessity [sine necessitate], God, who foreknows all future things foreknows this very thing. So, what God foreknows necessarily [necessitate] is going to happen, just as it is foreknown. Accordingly, it is necessary [necesse est] for something to be going to happen without necessity. Therefore, for one who rightly understands this, the foreknowledge upon which necessity follows and the free choice from which necessity is removed do not seem contradictory at all, since it is necessary that God foreknows what is going to happen, and God foreknows something to be going to happen without any necessity. (S., p. 245)

The interlocutor raises several objections. The first is easily resolved, since it consists in simply shifting the ground from actions in general to sinning. Since God foreknows whether a person will sin or not, it seems that it is then necessary that a person sins or does not sin. Anselm simply makes explicit the full significance of what is being asserted, after which it is clear that framing the issue in terms of sin simply generates the same structure. “You should not say just: ‘God foreknows that I am going to sin or I am not going to sin,’ but rather: ‘God foreknows that without necessity I am going to sin or I am not going to sin.’” (S., p. 246)

The second objection raises a puzzle that stems from the sense of “necessity.” “Necessity seems to mean [sonare] compulsion or restraint [coactionem uel prohibitionem]. So, if it is necessary that I sin from my willing, I understand myself to be compelled by some hidden force to the will to sin; and if I do not sin, I am restrained from the will to sin.” (S., p. 246-7) In response, Anselm notes that some things are said to necessarily be or not be, even when there is no compulsion or restraint. In the case of voluntary actions, God foreknows them, but this foreknowledge does not produce any compulsion or restraint. To the contrary, God foreknows them precisely as voluntary actions. There is a necessity involved, but one that “follows,” rather than “precedes,” or determines, the thing or event.

Anselm provides examples of these two modalities of necessity. An uprising that is going to take place tomorrow does not occur by necessity. It could happen otherwise, although it will not. The sun rising tomorrow will happen by necessity. It must happen that way.

The uprising, which will not be from necessity, is asserted to be going to happen only by a following necessity [sequenti necessitate], since what is going to happen is being said of what is going to happen. For, if it is going to happen tomorrow, by necessity it is going to happen. The sunrise, however, is understood to be going to happen by both kinds of necessity, namely the preceding [praecedenti] necessity that makes the thing be – so it will be, since it is necessary [necesse est] that it be – and the following necessity that does not compel it to be. (S., p. 250)

When one says that it is necessary for what God foreknows to happen, care is needed lest these different modalities of necessity get mixed up. In the case of human willing, the necessity is of the following, not the preceding kind. There is a temporality involved in the necessity of human will.

What the free will wills, the free will can and cannot not-will [non velle], and it is necessary that it will. For, it can not-will before it wills, since it is free, and once it wills, it cannot not-will, but rather it is necessary that it will, since it is impossible for it to will and not will the same thing at the same time. . . . there is a twofold necessity, because [what the will freely wills] is compelled to be by the will, and what happens cannot at the same time not happen. But the free will makes these necessities, which can avoid them [coming to be] before they are. (S., p. 251)

Far from free will being incompatible with necessity and with God’s foreknowledge, free will is in fact productive of some necessity. Anselm employs a line of reasoning similar to that used in earlier works, most notably in the De Veritate. “Why then is it something astonishing if in this way something is from freedom and from necessity, when there are many things that are grasped in opposite ways by changing the point of view [diverse ratione]?” (S., p. 253) Employing this technique of distinction allows him the conclude that they are in fact compatible: “No inconsistency arises if, in accordance with the reasons given earlier, we assert one and the same thing to be necessarily going to be, since it is going to be, and that it is by no necessity compelled to be going to be, unless by that necessity that was said earlier to come to be from free will.” (S., p. 253)

In Chapter 5, ultimately in order to be able to provide a hermeneutic for seemingly problematic Scriptural passages, Anselm provides readers with an intellectual glimpse of eternity. Within eternity, there is no past or future, but only present; not the fleeting present of our temporal experience, but an eternal present, one that has an ontological priority over time as we experience it. “Although nothing is there except what is present, it is not the temporal present, like ours, but rather the eternal, within which all times altogether are contained. If in a certain way the present time contains every place and all the things that are in any place, likewise, every time is encompassed [clauditur] in the eternal present, and everything that is in any time.” (S., p. 254)

The nature of temporal things is that, insofar as they are in time, they do not always exist, and they change from time to time, whereas, as they exist in eternity, they always exist and are unchangeable. Anselm again frames this in terms of different points of view. Something can be able to be changed in time and still be unchangeable in eternity “For things that are changeable in time and unchangeable in eternity are not more opposed than not being in some time is to always being in eternity, or having been or going to be in accordance with time and not having been or not going to be in eternity.” (S., p. 255) This allows a fuller understanding of the relation between God’s foreknowledge and free choice. Before (in the temporal sequence) something is willed by a being existing in time, such as sinning or not sinning, it can be otherwise. It already exists in eternity, however, which is how God knows (or from our point of view, foreknows) it.

Anselm deals briefly with the second question or problem, reconciling predestination with free choice. This question seems to present a more problematic issue than divine foreknowledge. One can, as Anselm does, reconcile divine foreknowledge with free human choices by taking the position that God knows the free human choices as free, but from a vantage point of eternity, in which the free, uncompelled or restrained human actions have already happened, or more properly expressed are already happening. Predestination, however, seems to involve God making things happen the way they do. There is a possible resolution, however; we can say: “God predestines evil people and their evil works when he does not correct them and their evil works. But he is said to foreknow and predestine good things, because he causes [facit] that they be and that they be good; but for evil things, he only causes them to be what they are essentially, not that they are evil.” (S., p. 261) That is, (in accordance with the positions developed in Anselm’s earlier works), God never directly causes something evil, but rather provides the basis, in being and goodness, for what is then turned to evil, turned away from how it ought to be.

God does predestine human actions, according to Anselm, but he predestines them precisely as free or voluntary actions, which does not impose a necessity upon them that does not come from the choosing person’s willing, by the sort of following necessity discussed in relation to foreknowledge.

For God – even though He predestines – does not cause [facit] these things by compelling or restraining the will, but rather by committing [dimittendo] it to its own power. But even though the will uses its own power, it does nothing that God does not do in good things by his grace, in bad things not by fault of his own will but the will of the person. . . And just as foreknowledge, which does not err, only foreknows what is true, just as it will be, whether it is necessary or spontaneous, likewise, predestination . . . predestines a thing only as it is in foreknowledge. (S., p. 261)

The third question or problem is reconciling God’s grace and human free choice. In the course of showing that there is no real contradiction between these, Anselm’s treatment ranges over a number of issues. There are a variety of different viewpoints to be considered. Some, supporting themselves by appeal to Scripture, maintain that only divine grace leads to salvation; others, likewise appealing to other Scriptural passages, maintain that salvation depends on our will. Furthering the first position, some cite passages that seem to have good works and salvation depend on grace, and others point to the common enough experience of people who, despite their efforts, fail. In addition to Scriptural passages that teach that humans have free choice, or that urge people to do good and that condemn evil, there is a line of reasoning supporting free choice, namely: “If nobody were to do good or evil through free choice, then there would be no reason why [nec ullo modo esset cur] God justly gives what they deserve [retribueret] to good people and bad people on account of the merits of each one.” (S., p. 264)

The position that Anselm develops can be summarized as the following: Grace and free choice are not only compatible, but they in fact cooperate with each other. So, setting aside the exception of baptized infants, grace and free choice are both required for one to be saved. The ways in which grace and free choice cooperate with each other, as well as the ways in which free choice fails to cooperate with grace, are complex. Four main features of this are: the relationship between uprightness or righteousness (rectitudo) and grace; the need for cooperation with grace through one’s will; Anselm’s threefold distinction about the will; and the will for happiness and the will for justice.

Uprightness of will was discussed at length in Anselm’s earlier works, but it receives a more sophisticated and nuanced treatment in the De Concordia. As before: “There is no doubt that the will only wills rightly [recte] when it is upright [recta]. . . the will is not upright because it wills rightly, but it wills rightly because it is upright.” (S., p. 265-6) When the will wills uprightness for its own sake, it quite clearly wills rightly, and as in the earlier works, the will thereby wills to remain in this uprightness. In the De Concordia treatment, however, it is possible for one to will more uprightness. “I do not deny that an upright will wills an uprightness it does not yet have, when it wills to have a greater uprightness than it has; but I say that no will can will uprightness, if it does not have the uprightness by which it wills it.” (S., p. 266)

Later, Anselm says something very similar:

It is said to those already converted [i.e. turned towards God, conservis]: “be converted,” either so that they are further converted or so that they keep themselves converted. For, those who say: “convert us, God,” are already in some way converted, since they have an upright will when they will to be converted. But they pray through what they have received so that their conversion be augmented, just like those who were believers and said: “increase our faith.” It is as if both of these groups said: “increase in us what you gave us, bring to fruition [perfice] what you began. (S., p. 272)

When one has uprightness, one can will to preserve it, but lacking it, one cannot simply will oneself to have it, and then thereby have it. In addition, a creature cannot have uprightness from itself, nor can it have it from another creature. Instead, it can only have it through God’s grace.

Grace, as Anselm states clearly, is not something simple to pin down. For one, there are many different ways in which grace is bestowed. As Anselm says, he is “not up to the task [non. . .valeam] – for it does this in many ways – of enumerating the ways in which, after this uprightness has been received, grace aids free choice to keep what it received.” (S., p. 267) For another, graces follow on graces, and this takes place in more than one way as well. For instance: “If the will, by free choice keeping what it received, merits either an augmentation of the justice it has received, or even the power for a good will, or some sort of reward, all of these are fruits of the first grace, and “grace for grace,” and therefore all of this is to be imputed to grace. . .” (S., p. 266-7)

Free choice can cooperate with grace, grace that is first given, that is to say, the giving of the uprightness that the will receives by free choice, and then, in keeping this righteousness, cooperates with grace again. The grace can only be lost by the choices made to abandon uprightness in favor of something else. Worthy of note, in this treatise, Anselm gives a concrete example of this sort of grace. “This uprightness is never separated from the will except when it wills something else that is not in harmony with this uprightness. Just as when somebody receives the uprightness of willing sobriety, and they reject it by wiling an immoderate pleasure of drinking. (S., p. 267)

In Anselm’s view, graces are offered in many ways, even at the moments when one is deciding. He give several examples of how grace assists the free choice of the will when one is tempted to abandon the uprightness one has received, “by mitigating or even entirely cancelling the force of the besieging temptation, or by augmenting the affection of that same uprightness.” (S., p. 268) Anselm supplies a principle of interpretation in these matters: “In short, since everything is subject to God’s ordination, whatever happens to a person that aids the free choice to receiving or keeping that uprightness of which I speak, is to be imputed entirely to grace.” (S., p. 268)

In his explanation of the extended metaphor of cultivation in Book 3, Chapter 6, Anselm provides further examples of grace, showing grace coming from grace and the involvement of free choice at each point. The metaphor is:

[J]ust as the earth, without any cultivation by humans, brings forth innumerable herbs and trees without which human nature is nourished or by which it is even destroyed, those that most necessary to us for nourishing life [are not brought forth] without great labor and cultivation, and not without seeds. Likewise the human hearth, without teaching, without application [studio] spontaneously germinates thoughts and willings [voluntates] that are of no use for salvation or are even harmful, whereas those, without which we make no progress to salvation of the soul, never conceive and germinate without a seed of their own sort and laborious cultivation. (S., p. 270)

Grace, the seed, involves, even requires human participation and effort, and at the same time aids the human effort at nearly every turn. Grace and human willing constantly interact.

That [preachers] are sent, is a grace. And for this reason, preaching is a grace, since what comes down from grace is grace; and hearing [the Word preached] is grace, and understanding what is heard is grace, and uprightness of wiling is grace. Truly sending, preaching, hearing, understanding are nothing unless the will wills what the mind understands. . . So, what the mind conceives from hearing the Word is the seed of preaching and uprightness is the “growth” [incrementum] that God gives, without which “neither he who plants nor he who waters is anything, but rather God who gives the growth.” (S., p. 271)

Anselm’s discussion of the will in the De Concordia revisits some of the same doctrines developed in earlier works. A person is not forced by temptation or oppression to abandon uprightness of will, but rather fails to will to keep it because he or she wills something else. What a person wills, they either will on account of uprightness or some benefit. These motives can, and in some cases do, clash with each other. There is a finer analysis of the will, one used later as the starting point in the De Moribus attributed to Anselm.

Since particular instruments have what they are [hoc quod sunt], and their aptitudes, and their uses, let us distinguish in the will that on account of which we call it an instrument, its aptitudes, and its uses. These aptitudes in the will we can call “affections,” since the instrument of willing is affected by its aptitudes.The will is spoken of equivocally, and in three ways. For, the instrument of willing is one thing, the affection of the instrument is another, and the use of this same instrument is yet another. The instrument of willing is that power [vis] of the soul that it uses for willing . . . The affection of this instrument is that by which this instrument itself is affected to willing something even when it does not think about what it wills . . . . The use of this very instrument is what we have only when we think about the thing that we will. (S., p. 280)

There is only one instrument of willing, and the instrument itself does not admit of degrees. There are many uses of the will, that is, actual willings in concrete situations, using the instrument of the will. There are multiple affections or aptitudes of the will, and they do admit of greater and lesser degrees. Anselm states that all of these can be regarded as different wills, since they are not identical (they are distinguishable without being separable). The distinction also allows clarification of the agency of the will: “The will as instrument moves all of the other instruments that we freely [sponte] use, both those that are part of us – like hand, tongue, sight – and those external to us – like pen, hatchet – and causes [facit] all of our voluntary motions. Indeed, it moves itself through its own affection, whence it can be called an instrument that moves its very self.” (S., p. 283-4)

Two affections are of particular importance, and allow clarification of how one deserts justice or uprightness of will. “From these two affections, which we still call ‘wills,’ all the merit of a person comes, whether good or bad. These two wills differ, however, because the one which is to willing benefit is inseparable, but the one for willing uprightness is separable.” (S., p. 284) This means that the will to benefit, which Anselm also calls “will to happiness” (uoluntas beatitudinis) is always part of the human being, whereas the will to justice is not. A person can will justice or uprightness (if they have it), in which case they do have it, or a person can not. It is by deserting justice, or by not willing the will to justice, in order to will something else, meaning happiness of such a sort that it is incompatible with justice, that the will as a whole, and a person as a whole goes astray. This then happens by the use of the person’s free choice.

13. The Fragments

Anselm left behind fragments of an unfinished work that is of some philosophical interest. Stylistically, they appear to have been intended to be a full dialogue, and the portions that we possess are written in polished Latin style. Their content consists in analyses of concepts and terminology central to certain parts of Anselm’s work, and although the theme of uncritical acceptance of ordinary linguistic usage obscuring the real matters at hand is not a new one, the analyses are carried out to a degree of sophistication unparalleled by the extant works. The student begins the dialogue: “There are many matters regarding which I have for some time wished your response, among which are ability [potestas] and inability [impotentia], possibility and impossibility, necessity and freedom. I enumerate all of these together at the same time, because the knowledge of them seems to me to be mixed up together.” (u.W, p. 23)

The student is led to several absurd conclusions in reasoning about these matters, which Anselm treated in earlier works, for example reconciling God being omnipotent with God being unable to do certain things, or it being impossible for God to do those things. The teacher indicates that what is needed is an understanding of the meaning of the verb “to do” (facere), and of what is, properly speaking (proprie) “one’s own” (suum alicuius). “To do” (later, Anselm will indicate that agere, “to act” does this as well) has an interesting and unique status, since it is used colloquially as substitute for many other expressions, even including those involving “not doing” (non facere). The expressions which it may substitute for can be the proper responses to the question: “what is he/she doing?”

The teacher then introduces several discussions about causes. “[E]verything of which any verb is said [i.e. any subject of which a verb is predicated], is some cause for what is signified by that verb being the case. And, every cause, in ordinary linguistic usage [usu loquendi] is said to “make” or do” [facere] what it is the cause of.” (u.W, p. 26) Some of these are straightforward, such as a person running causes that there is running. Some of these are not quite so straightforward. “For, in this way, one who sits, makes there to be sitting, and one who suffers, makes there to be suffering, because if the one who suffers were not to be, there would not be a suffering.” (u.W, p. 26) In addition, the being or nature of a thing is a cause for what can be said of it. “If, for example, we say: ‘(a) human being is an animal,’ (a) human being is a cause that there be an animal and that it be said that ‘there is animal.’ I do not mean that (a) human being is the cause for animal existing, but rather that (a) human being is the cause that it be and be called (an) animal. For by this name the entire human being is signified and conceived, in which whole animal is as a part.” (u.W, p. 27-8)

Next, the teacher notes that there are different ways (modis usus loquendi) of using the verb “to do,” “to make,” or “to cause” (facere), and although he concedes that their division is numerous and quite complicated (multiplex et nimis implicata), he advances a sixfold division of causing things to be or not to be.

Two ways, when:

it causes what it is said to cause, or

it does not cause what it is said to cause not to be

Four ways, when it causes or does not cause something else to be or not to be. For we say something to cause another thing to be, because. . . .

it causes something else to be, or

it does not cause something else to be, or

because it causes something else not to be, or

because it does not cause something else not to be. (u.W, p. 29)

He provides examples of each of these:

. . . when somebody is said to cause another person to be dead by slaying him or her with a sword.

The only example . . . I have is if I posit someone who could resuscitate a dead person, but does not will to do so. . . . In other matters, examples are abundant, as when we say that somebody causes an evil to be, one that, when he or she is able to, that somebody does not cause it not to be.

. . . when it is asserted that someone killed another . . . because he or she ordered that the other be killed, or because he or she caused the killer to have a sword, or because he or she accused the one who was killed . . . . These people do not cause per se what is said to be caused . . . .but by doing something else . . . they act through an intermediary.

. . .when we pronounce someone to have killed another, who did not provide arms to the one who was killed before he or she was killed, or who did not retrain the killer, or who did not do something that, had he or she done it, the person would not have been killed

. . . by taking away the arms, one causes the one who is about to be killed to be disarmed, or by opening a door one causes the killer not to be closed up where he or she had been detained

. . . when by not disarming the killer, one does not cause them not to be armed, or by not leading the one who would be killed away, so that they would not be in the killer’s presence. (u.W, p. 29-30)

The same six modes also hold for “to cause not to be” (facere non esse), and Anselm provides examples for them as well. In all but the first mode, the one who is supposed to cause something does not cause it directly. Likewise, the modes hold for “not to cause to be” (non facere esse) and “not to cause not to be” (non facere non esse). These tools for analysis, the teacher suggests, can be used for other verbs, for “is” (esse), and for “ought” or “owes” (debere), allowing restatement of the expressions in forms better signifying what is really meant by the expressions.

Willing, or “to will” (velle) presents an interesting set of conditions, for it parallels “to do” or “to cause.” “We say ‘to will’ in the same six modes as ‘to cause to be.’ Likewise, we say ‘to will not to be’ in all of the different ways as ‘to cause not to be.’” (u.W, p. 37) This expression can also be dealt with under a fourfold division. In the first, “efficient will” (efficiens), “we will in such a way that [ut], if we are able to, we cause to be what we will.” (u.W, p. 38) In another type of willing, “approving will” (approbans), “[w]e will something that we are able to cause to be but we do not cause to be, but still, if it happens, it pleases us, and we approve of it.” (u.W, p. 38) In yet another type of willing, “conceding will” (concedens), “we will something. . . like a creditor who, being indulgent, wills to accept from a debtor barley in place of the wheat [the debtor owes].” (u.W, p. 38) In the last kind, “someone is said to will what one neither approves nor concedes, but rather permits, when one could prohibit it.” (u.W, p. 38)

There is an order of implication to these wills as well:

[T]he one that I have called “efficient will,” when it wills, so far as it is able, it causes it, and it also approves it, concedes it, and permits it. The “approving” will does not cause what it wills, but it does approve it, concede it, and permit it. The “conceding” will does not cause or approve what it wills, unless on account of something else, but it does concede and permit it. The “permitting” will does not cause, or approve, or concede what it wills, but only permits it even though it disapproves of it. (u.W, p. 38-9)

These categories of analysis can be extended not simply to human willing, but also to the divine will, addressing some of the issues about the divine will and its compatibility with evil human or angelic acts raised and dealt with in the earlier works.

Anselm also provides further classification of causes. Some causes are efficient causes, for instance the maker of an object, or the wisdom that makes somebody wise. Other causes are not efficient causes, including the matter from which something is made, or space and time, within which spatial and temporal things (localia et temporalia) come to be. All of these are causes in some sense, since they all have some role in what is, or is not, being so.

Anselm also distinguishes between proximate, or immediate causes and distant, or mediated causes. “Proximate causes are those that by themselves (per se) cause what they are said to cause, with no other mediate cause standing in between them and the effect that they cause, and distant [longinquae] causes are those that do not by themselves (per se) cause what they are said to cause, unless there is either one or more other mediating cause(s).” (u.W, p. 40) The first two modes of “to cause” discussed earlier apply to proximate causes, the other four to distant causes. Both efficient causes and non-efficient causes can be proximate or distant causes, although, as Anselm points out, strictly speaking, distant causes are themselves proximate causes of something at least: “Although very often causes are said to causes not by themselves (per se), but by another (per aliud), i.e. by a medium – whence they can be called distant causes – still every cause has its proximate effect that it causes by itself (per se) and whose proximate cause it is.” (u.W, p. 41) All causes are involved in a linking or network of causes and effects whose ultimate origin is God. “Every cause has causes going back all the way to the supreme cause of all, God, who since He is the cause of everything that is something, does not himself have a cause. Every effect whatsoever has many causes of diverse types, except for the first effect, since the supreme cause alone created everything.” (u.W, p. 41)

Anselm also discusses the meaning of “something” (aliquid) and “ability” (potestas) in the fragments, largely reiterating points made in earlier works.

14. Other Writings

Anselm produced other works beyond those summarized and excerpted from here, including theEpistola de Incarnatione Verbi (on the Incarnation of the Word), De Conceptu Virginali et de Originali Peccato (on the Virgin Conception and Original Sin), De Processione Spiritus Sancti (on the Procession of the Holy Spirit), all of which contain some philosophical reasoning as well as theological.

The last century has seen several other Anselmian texts made available to scholars. As noted earlier, theFragments come from an unfinished work edited and established by Dom F .S. Schmitt, O.S.B. Arguably of greater significance is the De Moribus (on Human Morals), edited and established by R. W. Southern and Dom Schmitt in Memorials of St. Anselm, which discusses the affections of the will at great length, in great detail, and through the use of many illuminating metaphors (similtudines). As Southern and Dom Schmitt note, this work was added to considerably and edited by an unknown redactor, then circulated and attributed to Anselm as the De Simultudinibus. Also included in that volume are the Dicta Anselmi (Anselm’s Sayings), assembled and redacted most likely by Anselm’s companion, the monk Alexander.

In addition, Anselm left behind numerous letters, prayers, and meditations, many of very high literary and spiritual quality.

15. References and Further Readings

Several readily accessible research bibliographies on Anselm exist. Two particularly useful ones are:

Kienzler, Klaus. International Bibliography: Anselm of Canterbury (Lewiston, New York: Edwin Mellen Press. 1999)
Miethe, T.L. “The Ontological Argument: A Research Bibliography,” The Modern Schoolman v. 54 (1977)

a. Primary Sources

The standard scholarly version of Anselm’s collected works is the edition by Dom F. S. Schmitt, O.S.B.S. Anselmi Cantuariensis Archiepiscopi Opera Omnia. 6 vols. (Edinburgh: Thomas Nelson and Sons. 1940-1961). It was reprinted in 1968 by F. Fromann Verlag (Stuttgart-Bad Cannstatt), and is available currently on CD-ROM from Past Masters.

Additional Latin writings may be found in Memorials of St. Anselm. R. W. Southern and F. S. Schmitt, O.S.B. eds. (Oxford University Press. 1969), and in Ein neues unvollendetes Werk des heilige Anselem von Canterbury, F. S. Schmitt, O.S.B., ed. (Munster: Aschendorf. 1936)

There are numerous English translations of Anselm’s works. Below are several of the most common:

St. Anselm’s Proslogion. Trans. M.J. Charlesworth. (Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press, 1965)
Anselm of Canterbury: The Major Works. Trans. Brian Davies and Gillian Evans (New York: Oxford University Press, 1998)
St. Anselm: Basic Writings. Trans. S. N. Deane (La Salle, Illinois: Open Court Press, 1962)
The Letters of Saint Anselm of Canterbury. 3 vols. Trans. Walter Frohlich. (Kalamazoo, Michigan: Cistercian Publications. 1990-1994)
Truth, Freedom, and Evil: Three Philosophical Dialogues. Trans. Jasper Hopkins and Herbert Richardson (New York. 1967)
Anselm of Canterbury. Trans. Jasper Hopkins and Herbert Richardson (Toronto: Edwin Mellen. 1976). Includes, as v. 4, Jasper Hopkin’s Hermeneutical and Textual Problems in the Complete Treatises of St. Anselm.
A New Interpretive Translation of St. Anselm’s Monologion and Proslogion. Trans. Jasper Hopkins (Minneapolis: Arthur J. Banning. 1980)
The Prayers and Meditations of Saint Anselm. Trans. Benedicta Ward (New York: Penguin Books. 1973)
Anselm: Monologion and Proslogion. Trans. Thomas Williams. (Indianapolis: Hackett. 1995)
Anselm: Three Philosophical Dialogues. Trans. Thomas Williams. (Indianapolis: Hackett. 2002)

b. Secondary Sources

In addition to the works referenced below, the entirety of the occasional volumes comprising Analecta Anselmiana, Spicilegium Beccense, and Anselm Studies are all to be highly recommended, as is The Saint Anselm Journal, which is online and affiliated with the Institute for Saint Anselm Studies.

Adams, Marilyn McCord. “Fides Quaerens Intellectum: St. Anselm’s Method In Philosophical Theology,” Faith and Philosophy, vol. 9, n. 4 (1992)
Barth, Karl. Anselm: Fides Quaerens Intellectum. Trans. Ian Robertson (Richmond: John Knox Press. 1960)
Baumstein, Dom Paschal, O.S.B. “Anselm Agonistes: The Dilemma of a Benedictine Made Bishop,”Faith and Reason, v. 13 (1997-8)
Baumstein, Dom Paschal, O.S.B. “Revisiting Anselm: Current Historical Studies and Controversies,”Cistercian Studies Quarterly, v. 28 (1993)
Baumstein, Dom Paschal, O.S.B. “St. Anselm and the Prospect of Perfection,” Faith and Reason, v. 29 (2004)
Bayert, J, S.J. “The Concept of Mystery According to St. Anselm of Canterbury,” Recherches de Théologie ancienne et médiévale, v. 9 (1937)
Châtillon, Jean. “De Guillaume d’Auxerre à S. Thomas d’Aquin: l’argument de S. Anselme chez les premiers scholastiques du XIIIe siècle,” Spicilegium Beccense, v. 1. (Paris: Vrin. 1959)
Cohen, Nicholas. “Feudal Imagery or Christian Tradition? A Defense of the Rationale for Anselm’s Cur Deus Homo,” The Saint Anselm Journal, v. 2, n. 1 (2004)
Corbin, Michel, S.J. “La significations de l’unum argumentum du Proslogion,” Anselm Studies, vol. 2 (1988)
Corbin, Michel, S.J. Prière et raison de la foi: introduction à l’œuvre de S. Anselme de Cantorbéry(Paris: Cerf. 1992)
Davies, Brian and Brian Leftow, eds. The Cambridge Companion to Anselm (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press. 2004)
Eadmer. Vita Sancti Anselmi, translated by R.W. Southern as The Life of St. Anselm: Archbishop of Canterbury (London: Thomas Nelson and Sons, Ltd. 1962).
Evans, Gillian Rosemary. A Concordance to the Works of St. Anselm (Millwood, New York: Kraus International Publications. 1984)
Evans, Gillian Rosemary. Anselm. (Wilton, Connecticut: Morehouse-Barlow. 1989)
Evans, Gillian Rosemary. Anselm and a New Generation (Oxford: Clarendon. 1980)
Evans, Gillian Rosemary. Anselm and Talking about God (New York: Oxford University Press. 1978)
Evans, Gillian Rosemary. “The ‘Secure Technician’: Varieties of Paradox in the Writings of Saint Anselm,” Vivarium, vol. 13 (1975)
Fortin, John, O.S.B., ed. Saint Anselm: His Origins and Influence (Lewiston, New York: Edwin Mellen Press. 2001)
Gilson, Etienne. “Sens et nature de l’argument de saint Anselme,” Archives d’histoire doctrinale et littéraire du Moyen Age, v. 9 (1934)
Hartshorne, Charles. Anselm’s Discovery (La Salle, Illinois: Open Court.1965)
Henry, D.P. “St Anselm on Scriptural Analysis,” Sophia, v. 1 (1962)
Herrera, R.A. Anselm’s Proslogion: An Introduction. (Washington D.C.: University Press of America. 1979)
Herrera, R.A. “St. Anselm’s Proslogion: A Hermeneutical Task,” Analecta Anselmiana, vol. 3 (1972)
Hick, John and Arthur C. McGill. The Many-faced Argument: Recent Studies on the Ontological Argument for the Existence of God (New York: MacMillan. 1967)
Hoegen, Maternus, ed. L’attualità filosofica di Anselmo d’Aosta (Rome: Pontifico Ateno S. Anselemo. 1990)
Hopkins, Jasper. A Companion to the Study of St. Anselm (Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press. 1972).
Koyré, Alexandre. L’idée de Dieu dans la philosophie de St. Anselme (Paris: Editions Ernest Leroux. 1923)
Matthews, Scott. Reason, Community and Religious Tradition: Anselm’s Argument and the Friars.(Aldershot: Ashgate: 2001)
McEvoy, James “La preuve anselmienne de l’existence de Dieu est-elle ontologique?,” Revue philosophique de Louvain, v. 92, n. 2-3 (1994).
McIntyre, J. St. Anselm and His Critics: A Reinterpretation of Cur Deus Homo (London. Edinburgh: Oliver and Boyd. 1954)
Paliard, Jacques “Prière et dialectique: Méditation sur le Proslogion de saint Anselme,” Dieu Vivant, v. 6 (1946)
Plantinga, Alvin. The Ontological Argument, from St. Anselm to Contemporary Philosophers(Garden City, New York: Anchor Books. 1965)
Pouchet, Dom Jean Robert, O.S.B. “Existe-t-il une ‘synthèse’ anselmienne,” Analecta Anselmiana, vol. 1 (1969)
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Author Information

Greg Sadler
Email: greg@reasonio.com
Marist College and ReasonIO
U. S. A.

A Priori and A Posteriori

The terms “a priori” and “a posteriori” are used primarily to denote the foundations upon which a proposition is known. A given proposition is knowable a priori if it can be known independent of any experience other than the experience of learning the language in which the proposition is expressed, whereas a proposition that is knowable a posteriori is known on the basis of experience. For example, the proposition that all bachelors are unmarried is a priori, and the proposition that it is raining outside now is a posteriori.

The distinction between the two terms is epistemological and immediately relates to the justification for why a given item of knowledge is held. For instance, a person who knows (a priori) that “All bachelors are unmarried” need not have experienced the unmarried status of all—or indeed any—bachelors to justify this proposition. By contrast, if I know that “It is raining outside,” knowledge of this proposition must be justified by appealing to someone’s experience of the weather.

The a priori /a posteriori distinction, as is shown below, should not be confused with the similar dichotomy of the necessary and the contingent or the dichotomy of the analytic and the synthetic. Nonetheless, the a priori /a posteriori distinction is itself not without controversy. The major sticking-points historically have been how to define the concept of the “experience” on which the distinction is grounded, and whether or in what sense knowledge can indeed exist independently of all experience. The latter issue raises important questions regarding the positive, that is, actual, basis of a priori knowledge — questions which a wide range of philosophers have attempted to answer. Kant, for instance, advocated a “transcendental” form of justification involving “rational insight” that is connected to, but does not immediately arise from, empirical experience.

This article provides an initial characterization of the terms “a priori” and “a posteriori,” before illuminating the differences between the distinction and those with which it has commonly been confused. It will then review the main controversies that surround the topic and explore opposing accounts of a positive basis of a priori knowledge that seek to avoid an account exclusively reliant on pure thought for justification.

An Initial Characterization
The Analytic/Synthetic Distinction
The Necessary/Contingent Distinction
The Relevant Sense of “Experience”
The Relevant Sense of “Independent”
Positive Characterizations of the A Priori
References and Further Reading

1. An Initial Characterization

“A priori” and “a posteriori” refer primarily to how, or on what basis, a proposition might be known. In general terms, a proposition is knowable a priori if it is knowable independently of experience, while a proposition knowable a posteriori is knowable on the basis of experience. The distinction between a priori and a posteriori knowledge thus broadly corresponds to the distinction between empirical and nonempirical knowledge.

The a priori/a posteriori distinction is sometimes applied to things other than ways of knowing, for instance, to propositions and arguments. An a priori proposition is one that is knowable a priori and an a priori argument is one the premises of which are a priori propositions. Correspondingly, an a posteriori proposition is knowable a posteriori, while an a posteriori argument is one the premises of which are a posteriori propositions. (An argument is typically regarded as a posteriori if it is comprised of a combination of a priori and a posteriori premises.) The a priori/a posteriori distinction has also been applied to concepts. An a priori concept is one that can be acquired independently of experience, which may – but need not – involve its being innate, while the acquisition of an a posteriori concept requires experience.

The component of knowledge to which the a priori/a posteriori distinction is immediately relevant is that of justification or warrant. (These terms are used synonymously here and refer to the main component of knowledge beyond that of true belief.) To say that a person knows a given proposition a priori is to say that her justification for believing this proposition is independent of experience. According to the traditional view of justification, to be justified in believing something is to have an epistemic reason to support it, a reason for thinking it is true. Thus, to be a priori justified in believing a given proposition is to have a reason for thinking that the proposition is true that does not emerge or derive from experience. By contrast, to be a posteriori justified is to have a reason for thinking that a given proposition is true that does emerge or derive from experience. (See Section 6 below for two accounts of the a priori/a posteriori distinction that do not presuppose this traditional conception of justification.) Examples of a posteriori justification include many ordinary perceptual, memorial, and introspective beliefs, as well as belief in many of the claims of the natural sciences. My belief that it is presently raining, that I administered an exam this morning, that humans tend to dislike pain, that water is H₂O, and that dinosaurs existed, are all examples of a posteriori justification. I have good reasons to support each of these claims and these reasons emerge from my own experience or from that of others. These beliefs stand in contrast with the following: all bachelors are unmarried; cubes have six sides; if today is Tuesday then today is not Thursday; red is a color; seven plus five equals twelve. I have good reasons for thinking each of these claims is true, but the reasons do not appear to derive from experience. Rather, I seem able to see or apprehend the truth of these claims just by reflecting on their content.

The description of a priori justification as justification independent of experience is of course entirely negative, for nothing about the positive or actual basis of such justification is revealed. But the examples of a priori justification noted above do suggest a more positive characterization, namely, that a priori justification emerges from pure thought or reason. Once the meaning of the relevant terms is understood, it is evident on the basis of pure thought that if today is Tuesday then today is not Thursday, or when seven is added to five the resulting sum must be twelve. We can thus refine the characterization of a priori justification as follows: one is a priori justified in believing a given proposition if, on the basis of pure thought or reason, one has a reason to think that the proposition is true.

These initial considerations of the a priori/a posteriori distinction suggest a number of important avenues of investigation. For instance, on what kind of experience does a posteriori justification depend? In what sense is a priori justification independent of this kind of experience? And is a more epistemically illuminating account of the positive character of a priori justification available: one that explains how or in virtue of what pure thought or reason might generate epistemic reasons? But before turning to these issues, the a priori/a posteriori distinction must be differentiated from two related distinctions with which it is sometimes confused: analytic/synthetic; and necessary/contingent.

2. The Analytic/Synthetic Distinction

The analytic/synthetic distinction has been explicated in numerous ways and while some have deemed it fundamentally misguided (e.g., Quine 1961), it is still employed by a number of philosophers today. One standard way of marking the distinction, which has its origin in Kant (1781), turns on the notion of conceptual containment. By this account, a proposition is analytic if the predicate concept of the proposition is contained within the subject concept. The claim that all bachelors are unmarried, for instance, is analytic because the concept of being unmarried is included within the concept of a bachelor. By contrast, in synthetic propositions, the predicate concept “amplifies” or adds to the subject concept. The claim, for example, that the sun is approximately 93 million miles from the earth is synthetic because the concept of being located a certain distance from the earth goes beyond or adds to the concept of the sun itself. A related way of drawing the distinction is to say that a proposition is analytic if its truth depends entirely on the definition of its terms (that is, it is true by definition), while the truth of a synthetic proposition depends not on mere linguistic convention, but on how the world actually is in some respect. The claim that all bachelors are unmarried is true simply by the definition of “bachelor,” while the truth of the claim about the distance between the earth and the sun depends, not merely on the meaning of the term “sun,” but on what this distance actually is.

Some philosophers have equated the analytic with the a priori and the synthetic with the a posteriori. There is, to be sure, a close connection between the concepts. For instance, if the truth of a certain proposition is, say, strictly a matter of the definition of its terms, knowledge of this proposition is unlikely to require experience (rational reflection alone will likely suffice). On the other hand, if the truth of a proposition depends on how the world actually is in some respect, then knowledge of it would seem to require empirical investigation.

Despite this close connection, the two distinctions are not identical. First, the a priori/a posteriori distinction is epistemological: it concerns how, or on what basis, a proposition might be known or justifiably believed. The analytic/synthetic distinction, by contrast, is logical or semantical: it refers to what makes a given proposition true, or to certain intentional relations that obtain between concepts that constitute a proposition.

It is open to question, moreover, whether the a priori even coincides with the analytic or the a posteriori with the synthetic. First, many philosophers have thought that there are (or at least might be) instances of synthetic a priori justification. Consider, for example, the claim that if something is red all over then it is not green all over. Belief in this claim is apparently justifiable independently of experience. Simply by thinking about what it is for something to be red all over, it is immediately clear that a particular object with this quality cannot, at the same time, have the quality of being green all over. But it also seems clear that the proposition in question is not analytic. Being green all over is not part of the definition of being red all over, nor is it included within the concept of being red all over. If examples like this are to be taken at face value, it is a mistake to think that if a proposition is a priori, it must also be analytic.

Second, belief in certain analytic claims is sometimes justifiable by way of testimony and hence is a posteriori. It is possible (even if atypical) for a person to believe that a cube has six sides because this belief was commended to him by someone he knows to be a highly reliable cognitive agent. Such a belief would be a posteriori since it is presumably by experience that the person has received the testimony of the agent and knows it to be reliable. Thus it is also mistaken to think that if a proposition is a posteriori, it must be synthetic.

Third, there is no principled reason for thinking that every proposition must be knowable. Some analytic and some synthetic propositions may simply be unknowable, at least for cognitive agents like us. We may, for instance, simply be conceptually or constitutionally incapable of grasping the meaning of, or the supporting grounds for, certain propositions. If so, a proposition’s being analytic does not entail that it is a priori, nor does a proposition’s being synthetic entail that it is a posteriori.

This raises the question of the sense in which a claim must be knowable if it is to qualify as either a priori or a posteriori. For whom must such a claim be knowable? Any rational being? Any or most rational human beings? God alone? There may be no entirely nonarbitrary way to provide a very precise answer to this question. Nevertheless, it would seem a mistake to define “knowable” so broadly that a proposition could qualify as either a priori or a posteriori if it were knowable only by a very select group of human beings, or perhaps only by a nonhuman or divine being. And yet, the more narrow the definition of “knowable,” the more likely it is that certain propositions will turn out to be unknowable. “Goldbach’s conjecture” – the claim that every even integer greater than two is the sum of two prime numbers – is sometimes cited as an example of a proposition that may be unknowable by any human being (Kripke 1972).

3. The Necessary/Contingent Distinction

A necessary proposition is one the truth value of which remains constant across all possible worlds. Thus a necessarily true proposition is one that is true in every possible world, and a necessarily false proposition is one that is false in every possible world. By contrast, the truth value of contingent propositions is not fixed across all possible worlds: for any contingent proposition, there is at least one possible world in which it is true and at least one possible world in which it is false.

The necessary/contingent distinction is closely related to the a priori/a posteriori distinction. It is reasonable to expect, for instance, that if a given claim is necessary, it must be knowable only a priori. Sense experience can tell us only about the actual world and hence about what is the case; it can say nothing about what must or must not be the case. Contingent claims, on the other hand, would seem to be knowable only a posteriori, since it is unclear how pure thought or reason could tell us anything about the actual world as compared to other possible worlds.

While closely related, these distinctions are not equivalent. The necessary/contingent distinction is metaphysical: it concerns the modal status of propositions. As such, it is clearly distinct from the a priori/a posteriori distinction, which is epistemological. Therefore, even if the two distinctions were to coincide, they would not be identical.

But there are also reasons for thinking that they do not coincide. Some philosophers have argued that there are contingent a priori truths (Kripke 1972; Kitcher 1980b). An example of such a truth is the proposition that the standard meter bar in Paris is one meter long. This claim appears to be knowable a priori since the bar in question defines the length of a meter. And yet it also seems that there are possible worlds in which this claim would be false (e.g., worlds in which the meter bar is damaged or exposed to extreme heat). Comparable arguments have been offered in defense of the claim that there are necessary a posteriori truths. Take, for example, the proposition that water is H₂O (ibid.). It is conceivable that this proposition is true across all possible worlds, that is, that in every possible world, water has the molecular structure H₂O. But it also appears that this proposition could only be known by empirical means and hence that it is a posteriori. Philosophers disagree about what to make of cases of this sort, but if the above interpretation of them is correct, a proposition’s being a priori does not guarantee that it is necessary, nor does a proposition’s being a posteriori guarantee that it is contingent.

Finally, on the grounds already discussed, there is no obvious reason to deny that certain necessary and certain contingent claims might be unknowable in the relevant sense. If indeed such propositions exist, then the analytic does not coincide with the necessary, nor the synthetic with the contingent.

4. The Relevant Sense of “Experience”

In Section 1 above, it was noted that a posteriori justification is said to derive from experience and a priori justification to be independent of experience. To further clarify this distinction, more must be said about the relevant sense of “experience”.

There is no widely accepted specific characterization of the kind of experience in question. Philosophers instead have had more to say about how not to characterize it. There is broad agreement, for instance, that experience should not be equated with sensory experience, as this would exclude from the sources of a posteriori justification such things as memory and introspection. (It would also exclude, were they to exist, cognitive phenomena like clairvoyance and mental telepathy.) Such exclusions are problematic because most cases of memorial and introspective justification resemble paradigm cases of sensory justification more than they resemble paradigm cases of a priori justification. It would be a mistake, however, to characterize experience so broadly as to include any kind of conscious mental phenomenon or process; even paradigm cases of a priori justification involve experience in this sense. This is suggested by the notion of rational insight, which many philosophers have given a central role in their accounts of a priori justification. These philosophers describe a priori justification as involving a kind of rational “seeing” or perception of the truth or necessity of a priori claims.

There is, however, at least one apparent difference between a priori and a posteriori justification that might be used to delineate the relevant conception of experience (see, e.g., BonJour 1998). In the clearest instances of a posteriori justification, the objects of cognition are features of the actual world which may or may not be present in other possible worlds. Moreover, the relation between these objects and the cognitive states in question is presumably causal. But neither of these conditions would appear to be satisfied in the clearest instances of a priori justification. In such cases, the objects of cognition would appear (at least at first glance) to be abstract entities existing across all possible worlds (e.g., properties and relations). Further, it is unclear how the relation between these objects and the cognitive states in question could be causal. While these differences may seem to point to an adequate basis for characterizing the relevant conception of experience, such a characterization would, as a matter of principle, rule out the possibility of contingent a priori and necessary a posteriori propositions. But since many philosophers have thought that such propositions do exist (or at least might exist), an alternative or revised characterization remains desirable.

All that can be said with much confidence, then, is that an adequate definition of “experience” must be broad enough to include things like introspection and memory, yet sufficiently narrow that putative paradigm instances of a priori justification can indeed be said to be independent of experience.

5. The Relevant Sense of “Independent”

It is also important to examine in more detail the way in which a priori justification is thought to be independent of experience. Here again the standard characterizations are typically negative. There are at least two ways in which a priori justification is often said not to be independent of experience.

The first begins with the observation that before one can be a priori justified in believing a given claim, one must understand that claim. The reasoning for this is that for many a priori claims experience is required to possess the concepts necessary to understand them (Kant 1781). Consider again the claim that if something is red all over then it is not green all over. To understand this proposition, I must have the concepts of red and green, which in turn requires my having had prior visual experiences of these colors.

It would be a mistake, however, to conclude from this that the justification in question is not essentially independent of experience. My actual reason for thinking that the relevant claim is true does not emerge from experience, but rather from pure thought or rational reflection, or from simply thinking about the properties and relations in question. Moreover, the very notion of epistemic justification presupposes that of understanding. In considering whether a person has an epistemic reason to support one of her beliefs, it is simply taken for granted that she understands the believed proposition. Therefore, at most, experience is sometimes a precondition for a priori justification.

Second, many contemporary philosophers accept that a priori justification depends on experience in the negative sense that experience can sometimes undermine or even defeat such justification. This counters the opinions of many historical philosophers who took the position that a priori justification is infallible. Most contemporary philosophers deny such infallibility, but the infallibility of a priori justification does not in itself entail that such justification can be undermined by experience. It is possible that a priori justification is fallible, but that we never, in any particular case, have reason to think it has been undermined by experience. Further, the fallibility of a priori justification is consistent with the possibility that only other instances of a priori justification can undermine or defeat it.

Nonetheless, there would appear to be straightforward cases in which a priori justification might be undermined or overridden by experience. Suppose, for instance, that I am preparing my tax return and add up several numbers in my head. I do this carefully and arrive at a certain sum. Presumably, my belief about this sum is justified and justified a priori. If, however, I decide to check my addition with a calculator and arrive at a different sum, I am quite likely to revise my belief about the original sum and assume that I erred in my initial calculation. It seems clear that my revised belief would be justified and that this justification would be a posteriori, since it is by experience that I am acquainted with what the calculator reads and with the fact that it is a reliable instrument. This is apparently a case in which a priori justification is corrected, and indeed defeated, by experience.

It is important, however, not to overstate the dependence of a priori justification on experience in cases like this, since the initial, positive justification in question is wholly a priori. My original belief in the relevant sum, for example, was based entirely on my mental calculations. It “depended” on experience only in the sense that it was possible for experience to undermine or defeat it. This relation of negative dependence between a priori justification and experience casts little doubt on the view that a priori justification is essentially independent of experience.

6. Positive Characterizations of the A Priori

A priori justification has thus far been defined, negatively, as justification that is independent of experience and, positively, as justification that depends on pure thought or reason. More needs to be said, however, about the positive characterization, both because as it stands it remains less epistemically illuminating than it might and because it is not the only positive characterization available.

How, then, might reason or rational reflection by itself lead a person to think that a particular proposition is true? Traditionally, the most common response to this question has been to appeal to the notion of rational insight. Several historical philosophers (e.g., Descartes 1641; Kant 1781) as well as some contemporary philosophers (e.g., BonJour 1998) have argued that a priori justification should be understood as involving a kind of rational “seeing” or grasping of the truth or necessity of the proposition in question. Consider, for instance, the claim that if Ted is taller than Sandy and Sandy is taller than Louise, then Ted is taller than Louise. Once I consider the meaning of the relevant terms, I seem able to see, in a direct and purely rational way, that if the conjunctive antecedent of this conditional is true, then the conclusion must also be true. According to the traditional conception of a priori justification, my apparent insight into the necessity of this claim justifies my belief in it. Its seeming to me in this clear, immediate, and purely rational way that the claim must be true provides me with a compelling reason for thinking that it is true. Therefore, the following more positive account of a priori justification may be advanced: one is a priori justified in believing a certain claim if one has rational insight into the truth or necessity of that claim.

While phenomenologically plausible and epistemically more illuminating than the previous characterizations, this account of a priori justification is not without difficulties. It would seem, for instance, to require that the objects of rational insight be eternal, abstract, Platonistic entities existing in all possible worlds. If this is the case, however, it becomes very difficult to know what the relation between these entities and our minds might amount to in cases of genuine rational insight (presumably it would not be causal) and whether our minds could reasonably be thought to stand in such a relation (Benacerraf 1973). As a result of this and related concerns, many contemporary philosophers have either denied that there is any a priori justification, or have attempted to offer an account of a priori justification that does not appeal to rational insight.

Accounts of the latter sort come in several varieties. One variety retains the traditional conception of a priori justification requiring the possession of epistemic reasons arrived at on the basis of pure thought or reason, but then claims that such justification is limited to trivial or analytic propositions and therefore does not require an appeal to rational insight (Ayer 1946). A priori justification understood in this way is thought to avoid an appeal to rational insight. The grounds for this claim are that an explanation can be offered of how a person might “see” in a purely rational way that, for example, the predicate concept of a given proposition is contained in the subject concept without attributing to that person anything like an ability to grasp the necessary character of reality. A priori justification is thereby allegedly accounted for in a metaphysically innocuous way.

But views of this kind typically face at least one of two serious objections (BonJour 1998). First, they are difficult to reconcile with what are intuitively the full range of a priori claims. While many a priori claims are analytic, some appear not to be, for instance, the principle of transitivity, the red-green incompatibility case discussed above, as well as several other logical, mathematical, philosophical, and perhaps even moral claims. It is possible, of course, to construe the notion of the analytic so broadly that it apparently does cover such claims, and some accounts of a priori justification have done just this. But this leads immediately to a second and equally troubling objection, namely, that if the claims in question are to be regarded as analytic, it is doubtful that the truth of all analytic claims can be grasped in the absence of anything like rational insight or intuition. Seeing the truth of the claim that seven plus five equals twelve, for instance, does not amount to grasping the definitions of the relevant terms, nor seeing that one concept contains another. Rather, it seems to involve something more substantial and positive, something like an intuitive grasping of the fact that if seven is added to five, the resulting sum must be – cannot possibly fail to be – twelve. But this of course sounds precisely like what the traditional view says is involved with the occurrence of rational insight.

A second alternative to the traditional conception of a priori justification emerges from a general account of epistemic justification that shifts the focus away from the possession of epistemic reasons and onto concepts like epistemic reasonability or responsibility. While presumably closely related to the possession of epistemic reasons, the latter concepts – for reasons discussed below – should not simply be equated with it. On accounts of this sort, one is epistemically justified in believing a given claim if doing so is epistemically reasonable or responsible (e.g., is not in violation of any of one’s epistemic duties).

This model of epistemic justification per se opens the door to an alternative account of a priori justification. It is sometimes argued that belief in many of the principles or propositions that are typically thought to be a priori (e.g., the law of noncontradiction) is in part constitutive of rational thought and discourse. This claim is made on the grounds that without such belief, rational thought and discourse would be impossible. If this argument is compelling, then quite apart from whether we do or even could have any epistemic reasons in support of the claims in question, it would seem we are not violating any epistemic duties, nor behaving in an epistemically unreasonable way, by believing them. Again, the possession of such beliefs is thought to be indispensable to any kind of rational thought or discourse. This yields an account of a priori justification according to which a given claim is justified if belief in it is rationally indispensable in the relevant sense (see, e.g., Boghossian 2000; a view of this sort is also gestured at in Wittgenstein 1969).

While views like this manage to avoid an appeal to the notion of rational insight, they contain at least two serious problems. First, they seem unable to account for the full range of claims ordinarily regarded as a priori. There are arguably a number of a priori mathematical and philosophical claims, for instance, such that belief in them (or in any of the more general claims they might instantiate) is not a necessary condition for rational thought or discourse. Second, these accounts of a priori justification appear susceptible to a serious form of skepticism, for there is no obvious connection between a belief’s being necessary for rational activity and its being true, or likely to be true. Consequently, it seems possible on such a view that a person might be a priori justified in thinking that the belief in question is true and yet have no reason to support it. In fact, given the epistemically foundational character of the beliefs in question, it may be impossible (once an appeal to a priori insight is ruled out) for a person to have any (noncircular) reasons for thinking that any of these beliefs are true. Views of this sort, therefore, appear to have deep skeptical implications.

A third alternative conception of a priori justification shifts the focus toward yet another aspect of cognition. According to externalist accounts of epistemic justification, one can be justified in believing a given claim without having cognitive access to, or awareness of, the factors which ground this justification. Such factors can be “external” to one’s subjective or first-person perspective. (Externalist accounts of justification obviously contrast sharply with accounts of justification that require the possession of epistemic reasons, since the possession of such reasons is a matter of having cognitive access to justifying grounds.) The most popular form of externalism is reliabilism. In broad terms, reliabilists hold that the epistemic justification or warrant for a given belief depends on how, or by what means, this belief was formed. More specifically, they ask whether it was formed by way of a reliable or truth-conducive process or faculty. Thus, according to reliabilist accounts of a priori justification, a person is a priori justified in believing a given claim if this belief was formed by a reliable, nonempirical or nonexperiential belief-forming process or faculty.

Reliabilist accounts of a priori justification face at least two of the difficulties mentioned above in connection with the other nontraditional accounts of a priori justification. First, they seem to allow that a person might be a priori justified in believing a given claim without having any reason for thinking that the claim is true. A person might form a belief in a reliable and nonempirical way, yet have no epistemic reason to support it. Accounts of this sort are therefore also susceptible to a serious form of skepticism. A second problem is that, contrary to the claims of some reliabilists (e.g., Bealer 1999), it is difficult to see how accounts of this sort can avoid appealing to something like the notion of rational insight. There are at least two levels at which this is so. First, the reliabilist must provide a more specific characterization of the cognitive processes or faculties that generate a priori justification. It is not enough simply to claim that these processes or faculties are nonempirical or nonexperiential. This in turn will require a more detailed account of the phenomenology associated with the operation of these processes or faculties. But what would a more detailed account of this phenomenology look like if it did not, in some way, refer to what traditional accounts of a priori justification characterize as rational insight? After all, reliable nonempirical methods of belief formation differ from those that are unreliable, such as sheer guesswork or paranoia, precisely because they involve a reasonable appearance of truth or logical necessity. And it is just this kind of intuitive appearance that is said to be characteristic of rational insight. Thus it appears that in working out some of the details of her account, the reliabilist will be forced to invoke at least the appearance of rational insight. Second, the reliabilist is obliged to shed some light on why the kind of nonempirical cognitive process or faculty in question is reliable. But here again it is difficult to know how to avoid an appeal to rational insight. How else could a given nonempirical cognitive process or faculty lead reliably to the formation of true beliefs if not by virtue of its involving a kind of rational access to the truth or necessity of these beliefs? It is far from clear to what else the reliabilist might plausibly appeal in order to explain the reliability of the relevant kind of process or faculty.

It appears, then, that the most viable reliabilist accounts of a priori justification will, like traditional accounts, make use of the notion of rational insight. Some reliabilist views (e.g., Plantinga 1993) do precisely this by claiming, for instance, that one is a priori justified in believing a given claim if this belief was produced by the faculty of reason, the operation of which involves rational insight into the truth or necessity of the claim in question. The plausibility of a reliabilist account of this sort, vis-à-vis a traditional account, ultimately depends, of course, on the plausibility of the externalist commitment that drives it.

7. References and Further Reading

Audi, Robert. 1999. “Self-Evidence,” Philosophical Perspectives, vol. 13, ed. James E. Tomberlin (Oxford: Blackwell), pp. 205-28.
Ayer, A.J. 1946. “The A Priori,” in Language, Truth and Logic, 2nd ed. (New York: Dover), pp. 71-87.
Bealer, George. 1999. “The A Priori,” in The Blackwell Guide to Epistemology, eds. John Greco and Ernest Sosa (Oxford: Blackwell), pp. 243-70.
Benacerraf, Paul. 1973. “Mathematical Truth,” The Journal of Philosophy 19: 661-79.
Boghossian, Paul. 2000. “Knowledge of Logic,” in New Essays on the A Priori (Oxford: Oxford University Press), pp. 229-54.
BonJour, Laurence. 1998. In Defense of Pure Reason (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press).
Casullo, Albert. 1992. “A priori/a posteriori,” in A Companion to Epistemology, eds. Jonathan Dancy and Ernest Sosa (Oxford: Blackwell), pp. 1-3.
Descartes, René. 1641. Meditations on First Philosophy, 3rd ed., trans. D.A. Cress (Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing Company, 1993).
Hamlyn, D.W. 1967. “A Priori and A Posteriori,” in The Encyclopedia of Philosophy, vol. 1, ed. Paul Edwards (New York: Macmillan Publishing Company & The Free Press), pp. 140-44.
Kant, Immanuel. 1781. Critique of Pure Reason, trans. N.K. Smith (London: Macmillan, 1929).
Kitcher, Philip. 1980a. “A Priori Knowledge,” Philosophical Review 89: 3-23.
Kitcher, Philip. 1980b. “A Priority and Necessity,” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 58: 89-101.
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Author Information

Jason S. Baehr
Email: Jbaehr@lmu.edu
Loyola Marymount University
U. S. A.

Wilfrid Sellars: Philosophy of Mind

The twentieth century philosophy of mind of Wilfrid Sellars (1912 – 1989) retains much from the traditional, Cartesian perspective. It endorses a realm of inner, private episodes of which we may have direct knowledge. However, Sellars rejects Cartesian substance dualism and the thesis that mental states are fully knowable simply by introspection. As an alternative, Sellars conceives of mental states by analogy with the postulation of microentities of theoretical physics, where thoughts and sensations are introduced to explain people’s behavior, including their use of language. Although thoughts and sensations are theoretical posits, direct or immediate knowledge of one’s own thoughts and sensations is possible, as are well-grounded judgments about others’ inner states. Concepts of thoughts are modeled on concepts of overt linguistic activity, and our knowledge of the nature of thinking is thus dependent upon the semantic categories and features appropriate to a public language. In this way, the traditional Cartesian view is retained to a certain extent, but also inverted. Thoughts and other inner episodes are genuine, private episodes, but knowledge of them is not the ground from which public facts are inferred. Instead, knowledge of thoughts, even our own, presupposes a language and knowledge of public matters. In fact, this is part of Sellars famous account of the Myth of the Given. A further important break from the Cartesian tradition comes in the distinct accounts Sellars provides for thoughts on the one hand, and sensations on the other. In this way Sellars is far more Kantian than Cartesian. Sellars’ theory of thinking is a proto-functionalist one, but is combined with a distinct account of sensation, one which stresses the intrinsic character of sensory experience. Mental episodes of thoughts and sensation are held by him to be reconcilable with a broadly naturalistic metaphysics.

The Cartesian Background
Requirements for a Theory of Mind
The Challenge of Mental Episodes
Sellars’ Positive Account: The Myth of Jones, I
Sellars’ Positive Account: The Myth of Jones, II
The Nature of Thinking and Sensing
References for Further Reading
1. Primary Texts
2. Secondary Texts

1. The Cartesian Background

Wilfrid Sellars (b.1912 – d.1989) was a systematic philosopher par excellence. As a consequence, attempts to understand his views on mind lead towards other areas of philosophy. In particular, Sellars’ theory of mind is intertwined with his views on language, epistemology, science, and metaphysics. This entry focuses on his account of mind and draws on these other areas only to the extent needed to shed light.

In keeping with his belief that philosophy is an ongoing dialogue, Sellars often develops his views in response to key historical figures. When it comes to the mind, Sellars finds himself often in dialogue with Descartes and it is here that we can begin to appreciate Sellars’ multi-faceted position. In particular, we might take Sellars’ point of departure to be Descartes’ belief that the mind is better known than the body. Sellars seeks to preserve the degree of truth it contains, while jettisoning components and presuppositions he views as problematic.

According to Descartes, our minds are better known than physical bodies in that nothing mental is in principle hidden from sight: knowledge we have of the mental realm is complete, direct, immediate, and not subject to doubt. While we may doubt whether we are seeing a tomato, we cannot doubt that we are sensing what seems to be a tomato. Nor can we doubt that we are thinking that there seems to be a tomato before us. Our awareness of the thought that there is a tomato before us is direct and infallible. Importantly for Descartes, all mental occurrences just are different kinds of thinking; the category of thinking includes such diverse mental events as sensings, wishings, imaginings, believings, hopings, willings, etc. and all will receive a similar treatment. Descartes is thereby said to endorse a sensory-cognitive continuum, something that Sellars (following Kant) will reject. Finally, and famously, Descartes held that such thinking cannot occur in material substance (res extensa), and so requires the existence of a distinct, independent type of substance, what he calls res cogitans. Special properties of thinking, such as immunity from doubt, are due to the special nature of this mental substance.

As we ponder Descartes’ views, we may find the claim that the mind is better known than the body quite plausible: while we can doubt whether our thoughts are accurate, we don’t seem able to doubt that we are having a certain thought. Further, we seem to know what is going on “inside” us better than anyone else could. Let us call this ability to know our own mental occurrences better than anyone else could the thesis of “First Person Authority.” It would be contrary to commonsense, it seems, to deny this First Person Authority and that alone gives us one good reason to maintain it. However, there are potential costs of doing so. First, in placing our thoughts within a privileged arena in which we know our own better than others do, we run the risk of generating skepticism about other people’s thoughts. We can begin to worry whether there are grounds for knowing what someone else is really thinking, and even whether there are other minds at all besides our own. If the mental is distinct from the behaviors of the body and knowable directly only by the subject of experience, can we be sure we are correct in our judgments about other people’s mental states? Can we be sure that there is anything “behind” the observable behavior of a person’s body? Second, many contemporary, scientifically inclined philosophers find Descartes’ reliance on an independent, mental substance troubling. It is by no means clear how to accomodate such a substance within a scientific, materialistic framework. How then are we to make use of Descartes’ apparent insights into the nature of the mind? We can understand Sellars as seeking to do just that—find a way to capture the intuition behind this First Person Authority, but in a way that is both scientifically respectable, and which doesn’t raise those skeptical worries. In what follows, we will see the complex account of mind that Sellars presents as an attempt to satisfy these various desiderata (and others as well).

2. Requirements for a Theory of Mind

Let us now explore more thoroughly and precisely the various elements Sellars believes a viable theory of mind requires. This will put us in a better position to understand the goals and objectives of the long story Sellars tells about minds, including what emerges in the famous “Myth of Jones.”

Now while Descartes assimilates all mental occurrences to the category thinking, it is worth noting that some mental events have a feature that others don’t. Let us consider for starters that class of mental episodes we call “beliefs.” One distinctive feature of beliefs is that they are about something. Our beliefs have a content, we might say, a subject matter. In contemporary terms, this is the intentionality of beliefs. Some of our mental occurrences are about something: they refer to something beyond themselves. We have beliefs about tables, about distant stars, about abstract states of affairs, about our own minds, and so on. In fact we might say, as some have, that the very mark of the mental is this intentionality. A theory of mind must, it seems, explain this intentionality. Let us henceforth reserve the term “thoughts” for that class of mental episodes which, like beliefs, have this property of intentionality. In that category of thoughts we can now include beliefs, but also wishes, hopes, judgments, and in general, anything mental that it makes sense to append with a that-clause. (For example, we believe that 2+2=4; we hope that it doesn’t rain; we think that summer is too short.) How is such intentionality possible?

Historically, some have taken this special property of the mental, intentionality, to be another reason to invoke a non-material substance into our worldview. Tables and chairs, it seems, can’t be said to be about anything. They don’t refer to anything. Nor does it seem that anything physical could be up to the job in a fundamental, non-derivative manner, as that just doesn’t seem like the right type of stuff. A philosophy of mind that seeks to be compatible with the dictates of science about the nature of reality will have to explain the intentionality of the mental, but again without reliance on something unscientific. This forms another part of the background of Sellars’ philosophy of mind.

Another feature of the mental that philosophers have focused on, something that has tempted philosophers to think of the mental realm as something importantly distinct from the physical realm, is the nature of conscious experience itself. So far we’ve focused on what we can do with our minds, our ability to think. But we are also subjects of rich experiences. We are conscious beings, and while that sometimes involves our reasoning, judging, believing, and the like, other times we simply take in the robust experiences we have. We listen to a poignant piece of music, we gaze upon a beautiful sunset, we savor a good drink. When we attend to these experiences, we find they have a unique, intrinsic character or quality. There is something it is like to hear a violin, a quality that isn’t present when we are just, say, thinking of how lovely a violin is. A theory of mind, it seems, must find a way to account for the existence and nature of these subjective, rich experiences.

Putting this all together, we might summarize as follows: a theory of mind should explain the existence of a broad class of episodes, ones we can lump together under the broad heading mental episodes. These seem to come in two types, what I’ll call cognitive and experiential. Cognitive mental episodes include believings, hopings, wishings, and so on. A mark of this class is their intentionality. Experiential mental episodes, on the other hand, include a sensation of warmth, a feeling of sadness, an experience of a blue patch. They have instead a qualitative character and dimension in a way that the cognitive episodes do not. Both cognitive and experiential mental episodes occupy a special place in our cognitive lives. In addition to the more obvious ways we care about their existence, many of them can be objects of immediate knowledge or awareness. Many of our thoughts and experiences are knowable in a direct, immediate manner, without reliance on inference, just as Descartes held. Let us call this immediate knowledge of mental episodes “non-inferential knowledge,” distinguishing such potential knowledge of mental episodes from the type of knowledge we have, for instance, about how things are on the far side of the moon. That is, our knowledge of these inner episodes often doesn’t have to be the product of any reasoning or inference. It is often just direct and immediate. And as we have seen, such episodes may also be the objects of First Person Authority. We seem to be in a position to somehow know our own better than others can. (Descartes goes even further, claiming that these episodes are incorrigible—our knowledge of them is so certain that we can’t even doubt their existence. But that is an extra step, one we need not take, even if we agree with Descartes on other points.)

As we proceed, we will explore Sellars’ attempt to explain all these features. One point is worth highlighting now, however. That we’ve divided these mental episodes into two types, cognitive and experiential, signals an important rejection of Descartes already. As mentioned, Descartes considers all mental occurrences to be thoughts, while Sellars, in contrast, believes it essential to distinguish these episodes. In short, while Descartes speaks of the mind-body problem, Sellars seeks to solve two mind-body problems; one concerning the nature of thinking, the other concerning the nature of sensing or experiencing.

3. The Challenge of Mental Episodes

We’ve noted that mental episodes are traditionally thought of as best known by the person who has them: they are private and known directly. Other people, in contrast it seems, can have at best indirect knowledge of our own. Why? Because traditionally conceived, such mental episodes exist within the private, inner realm of one’s mind and are only sometimes the cause of publicly observable behavior. I might grimace when my foot hurts, thereby giving evidence to others that I am in pain. But I might also stoically bear the pain. In this case I would be well aware of the inner episode of pain, but others may not be at all. This can generate skepticism about the existence of mental states, and of minds altogether. One radical solution to these skeptical worries was to simply equate the mental states with the behavior itself. In this way we need not worry, it was argued, about knowing someone’s mental states, for the mental states just are the various behaviors and dispositions to behave. On that view, to be in pain just is to grimace and yelp (and to have the disposition to do so, which sometimes might not be actualized). Importantly, Sellars rejects this strategy, known as Behaviorism. In contrast, Sellars holds that it is possible in principle to maintain the privacy of mental states, but in a way that doesn’t generate the skepticism that motivates the draconian Behaviorism. Showing how this is possible is the onus of Sellars’ positive account, which we will get to below. However, the problem of knowing mental states, even our own, is actually more complicated on Sellars’ view than we’ve seen so far. We need to now bring in other elements of Sellars’ philosophy, ones which both make knowledge of our own mental episodes more complicated but which also invite Sellars’ distinctive solution. Along the way we’ll discover the extent to which Sellars really is a systematic philosopher.

The additional complications and complexity arise when we consider another role mental episodes were traditionally called on to play. We’ve stressed Descartes’ view that the mind is better known than the body. By implication, Descartes holds that what we are actually in primary cognitive contact with is only our own inner states, our thoughts, feelings, beliefs, sensations, and so on. We have direct, immediate knowledge of these thoughts, and only of these thoughts. Our knowledge of the external, physical world, in contrast, is only by inference. For Descartes, our inferentially based knowledge of the material world is secured only if there exists a benevolent God who doesn’t allow certain of our thoughts, our clear and distinct ideas, to be in error. And although subsequent philosophers ceased to follow this theological grounding of our beliefs in the external, physical world, many did follow Descartes in holding that it is our private thoughts and sensations that are the only objects of direct, immediate knowledge. Our knowledge of the physical world, in contrast, is derived or inferentially dependent upon our more basic knowledge of these inner states.

Following Descartes, philosophers often speak of the “structure of knowledge”: highly theoretical knowledge is seen as resting on the (justified) foundation of more basic knowledge, and that on even more basic knowledge, and so on. But empirical knowledge is possible only if there is ultimately a stratum of most basic knowledge, which in some way involves our making cognitive contact with the world. It is natural to think that this most basic contact with the world involves our having sensory experiences. We can know the world, ultimately, because in some manner the world reveals itself to us through sensation. Or better yet, the world gives itself to us, in a form we can understand. If it didn’t, it would be hard to understand how we ever know anything. For Descartes, and for centuries of philosophers since, the basic knowledge which forms the foundation of knowledge is just the knowledge of our own inner states, our own thoughts, feelings, and sensations that we have from being in sensory contact with the world.

As for these inner states themselves, we both have them and also know them just by being in sensory contact with the world. In short, sensing the world was held, from Descartes on, to be sufficient for the production of inner states which we in turn know about just because of that sensory contact. For instance, simply sensing a red patch would be sufficient for knowing that we are sensing a red patch. We may doubt whether there really is a red patch there (maybe it is blue and the lighting misleads us), but our knowledge of the sensation of a red patch itself is immediate, direct, and a result simply of that sensing. The knowledge that we gain is, again, knowledge of our own sensations or thoughts.

As plausible as this picture seems, Sellars takes issue with it, referring to it as the Myth of the Given: that there are such sensory episodes that by their mere occurrence give us knowledge of themselves, is a myth to be dispelled, one to be replaced by a better account of the nature of sensing, thinking, and knowing. Of course, our aim here isn’t to explore Sellars’ reasons for thinking such episodes are mythological, nor to pursue his views on the nature of knowledge. Instead, we’ll address only what Sellars thinks is missing in this traditional account of knowledge of our inner, private episodes. Doing so will help explain why, according to Sellars, knowledge of even our own private episodes is itself much more complicated than the tradition held. Paradoxically, however, though knowledge of our own inner states is more complicated, explaining how it is possible will make our knowledge of other peoples’ inner episodes less complicated, less vulnerable to skepticism than traditionally thought.

What then is required for knowledge of our own inner, private episodes, say knowledge that I’m having a sensation of a red triangle, if it isn’t just that I am sensing a red triangle? What else is required besides the actual sensation? In short, knowledge requires concepts, and since concepts are linguistic entities, we can say that knowledge requires a language. To know something as simple as that the patch is red requires an ability to classify that patch, and Sellars thinks the only resource for such rich categorization as adult humans are capable of comes from a public language. Knowledge, and in fact all awareness, according to Sellars, is a linguistic affair. There is no such thing, accordingly, as preconceptual awareness or prelinguistic awareness or knowledge. Sellars calls this the thesis of “Psychological Nominalism,” and it is at the heart of his epistemology and theory of mind. We don’t know the world just by sensing it. We don’t even know our own sensations just by having them. We need a language for any awareness, including of our own sensations.

Importantly, this also creates a serious problem. Remember that Sellars is sympathetic to the claim of First Person Authority (even if it is to be modified or revised in some manner). Sellars does think that we can know our own thoughts better than others can. But his Psychological Nominalism threatens this, and threatens our claim to be able to know our thoughts at all. Consider how we could ever come to be aware of our thoughts and the like in the first place. Relying on the mythical Given would have helped, for we would be aware of such episodes just by having them. But we’ve rejected that account.

Instead, any awareness, even of our own thoughts, requires the concept of that of which we are to be aware. So, to be aware of a private, inner episode requires the concept of a private, mental episode. But how can I have the concept of something which is in me in a way that you can’t see? I can’t get it by noticing my own private sensations (as we’ve seen, that presupposes we already have the concept and the source of the concept is now what is in question!). Nor can I get the concept of a private episode by noticing yours, for it is private to you. And of course, you can’t notice yours, nor mine either! How do we, or anyone for that matter, get the concept of something hidden, inner, and private, in the first place? (Compare this with becoming aware of something public: I can learn the concept, cow, by, for starters having you point cows out to me. But that is because we have common, shared access to that object, which isn’t the case for private episodes).

Sellars has now forced us to confront the difficult question of the source and nature of the concept of an inner episode. What is the status of that concept? And how do speakers of a language come to have it, given that possession of it seems to be a condition for anyone noticing their own private episodes?

4. Sellars’ Positive Account: The Myth of Jones, I

This puzzle, and subsequent resolution, makes for one of the most famous planks in Sellars’ philosophy, spelled out in his landmark article, “Empiricism and the Philosophy of Mind.” The answer, ironically, comes in the form of a myth; the Myth of the Given is now replaced by Sellars’s own, Myth of Jones. This new myth has two parts: how we come to have the concept of inner episodes which are thoughts; and how we come to have the concept of inner episodes which are sensations. (Recall that Sellars takes issue with Descartes’ monolithic account of the mental). Common to both parts, however, is the telling of a story in which a group of people begin without a concept of certain inner, mental episodes, but gradually come to have both the concept and then direct awareness of the respective episodes. The myth, that is, takes seriously Sellars’ view that all awareness presupposes a language, and in the end, articulates the relationships between such concepts as public, private, thought, sensation, and so on.

Sellars begins the myth by having us imagine a group of beings who can talk and act just like we do, but who lack any vocabulary of the inner. They have no concepts or notions of thoughts, sensations, feelings, wants, desires, though their language is otherwise rich and complete, even having the resources for (proto)scientific theorizing. We now introduce the hero of the story, Jones, who himself proposes a theory. Importantly, like many theories designed to explain, this one posits the existence of a new class of entities. In this instance, Jones seeks to explain some of the behavior of his peers, and relying on an analogy with the method of postulation in physics (from our perspective), the entities Jones’ theory postulates of are, initially, unobservable. (To anticipate the end of the story, the entities Jones introduces, first thoughts, then sensations, are not in principle unobservable. His peers will eventually be able to direct, non-inferential knowledge of many of them).

What behavior, then, is Jones seeking to explain by the postulation of something he calls, “thoughts” and “thinking”? Namely that people sometimes engage in purposive, intelligent behavior when silent. Sometimes, that is, people engage in what we call, “thinking out loud,” where they speak about the intelligent behavior they are engaged in. But sometimes the behavior itself is present, with no accompanying verbal commentary, as it were. (Imagine someone changing the faucet in their kitchen, with instructions before them, sometimes reading aloud the instructions, sometimes declaring an intention to do something next, followed by periods of silence). What exactly, Jones wonders, is going on when people engage in such intelligent behavior when they are completely silent?

According to his theory, during all these occasions of intelligent behavior there is something going on “inside” people, in their heads if you like, some of which gets verbalized, some of which doesn’t. The way to explain such intelligent behavior is to see it as the culmination of a silent, inner type of reasoning, an “inner speaking” going on inside of people. Jones reasons that this intelligent behavior involves the occurrence of hidden episodes which are similar to the activity of talking. Jones says, in essence, “Let’s call it ‘thinking,’ and though it is like talking, it is silent, or covert inner speech. Thinking is what is going on in us, which lies behind and explains our intelligent behavior and our intelligent talking.”

Importantly, the episodes Jones postulates may turn out to be neuro-physiological events, but Jones’ theory is noncommittal on this point, and doesn’t require a specification of their intrinsic nature. The salient point is that episodes of thinking are modeled on a public language, and an understanding of these inner episodes will involve the use of categories that are in the first instance applicable to a public language.

Returning to this myth, we note that at the culmination of this first stage, Jones has only postulated the existence of these inner episodes—“inner” in being under the skin. In the second stage, Jones teaches his peers to use the theory to explain people’s behavior, in the absence of their “thinking out-loud.” Finally, and here is the crucial transition, Jones teaches people to apply the theory to themselves.

Having mastered the theory for third-person use, that is, people begin making inferences about themselves: “I just uttered such and such, so I must have been thinking such and such, (though I was not aware of it).” Eventually, by training and reinforcement from the community, people come to be able to actually report not just that they are thinking, but also what they are thinking, in a direct, non-inferential manner. Just as people can be trained to make immediate, non-inferential judgments about the nature of public objects, Jones’ pupils come to be able to issue non-inferential reports of their own thoughts, what is going on inside them, in a way that others aren’t. They can report directly about what is happening in their own minds, though according to Sellars, this has proceeded entirely within the constraints of Psychological Nominalism. Jones’ peers developed awareness of their own thoughts only after, or at least concurrently with, mastery of the public concepts (i.e. words) of “thinking”, “believing”, “wishing”, and so on, that comes with the learning of Jones’ theory itself.

Stepping back from the Myth of Jones, here are some of the significant points. The thesis of Psychological Nominalism claims that to be aware of something, x, one must have a concept for x. But there is a flip side to this. If one has a concept of x, one can be aware of x’s. With the concept of x in hand, that is, you can notice all sorts of things you didn’t notice before you had that concept. For instance, a physicist looks at a puff of smoke in a cloud chamber and sees an electron discharged. She comes to have non-inferential knowledge of something we might not, as she has certain concepts we don’t as laypeople, as well as an ability to apply them directly to her experience. In other words, perception is concept-laden, and depending on what concepts you have, you can perceive different things. (Sellars wasn’t the first to articulate this connection, but his development of it made for a revolutionary understanding of thinking and perception).

As a result, once we acquire the concept of an inner episode (as we saw for Jones’s peers), we can come to experience those episodes directly, though we were unaware of them before we had the concept. Non-inferential knowledge of the private is now possible, and so provides for a first person authority, as we sought. We are simply in a better position to report on our own thoughts (and sensations) than others. We can report on our own thoughts, for instance, because we have the concept of thinking. But others have that concept too—it is a public concept after all—and as such are in a position to also make judgments about our thinking. We may be in a better position than others, but others aren’t precluded from knowing our inner states. The skepticism that gave rise to Behaviorism can be avoided.

Yet while we do have an authority about our own inner states, it doesn’t follow that we are incorrigible about them, as Descartes held. All things being equal, you are in a better epistemic position to judge your own states than others are. There are times, however, when we aren’t the best judge of our inner episodes, of what we are feeling, for instance, as is well documented by psychotherapy. This weakening of the Cartesian view, however, affords retention of what Sellars sees as viable and valuable in Descartes’ philosophy.

Returning to the Myth of Jones, what he does for thoughts, Jones now does for sensations: recall Sellars’ view that sensations are importantly different from mental episodes that are thoughts. Though both are private, sensations differ in that they have an intrinsic, qualitative element in a way that thoughts and beliefs don’t. Further, sensations aren’t intentional: they aren’t about anything. Their postulation will have to be modeled, therefore, on something different than what was used for thoughts.

5. Sellars’ Positive Account: The Myth of Jones, II

Sellars’ account of sensations, the final chapter in the Myth of Jones, is designed to capture another important element in an overall theory of mind, namely that some of our private, mental episodes are a result of our sensory encounters with the world. By interacting with the world we are caused to have sensations, which vary from pain and pleasure, to sensations of blue triangles and pink ice cubes. As before, Jones offers a theory to explain public, observable behavior of his peers. In this case, Jones seeks to explain the fact that a person might utter “Red triangle there!” in cases both where there is one and in cases where there is not. Jones seeks to explain both veridical and non-veridical perceptual experiences, and how it is possible for people to have experiences that are qualitatively alike even though one may be an accurate representation and one not.

Jones theorizes that when a subject senses the physical world, something internal is registered, and this internal state has a qualitative element to it, one that can be caused by both genuine and illusory causes, to have the same qualitative element. Sensations, in other words, are postulated entities too, and are held to be the internal effects of outer, physical causes. Subjects are effected by these sensations, leading them to judge that there is, say a red triangle before them, both when there is one, but also, perhaps, even if there is only a white one in red light, for instance.

As before, these inner episodes are modeled on something public and observable—namely things like red triangles—and the inner episodes are said to be similar to these public objects, to be replicas, if you like, though of the sort that aren’t literally little triangles in minds. In this way, the public language of color and other qualities is used to characterize the nature of these episodes, and people learn to report, non-inferentially, on their own subjective experiences. As before, because individual reports of what is inner make use of a public language, the concepts employed in such reports are gained only once one has mastered that public language.

Considered in total, Jones’ theory of mental episodes has allowed Sellars to maintain our commonsense belief that there is a realm of experience, the inner, that is private and knowable by the subject of experience in a way that others can’t know it. At the same time, this has been done without reliance on a mysterious, unexplained power to access the inner realm, and has also allowed us to avoid the skepticism traditional accounts were faced with. The resources for describing and reporting on these episodes are the same resources available for describing public objects and events, and thus learnable by all. The Myth is anthropological fiction, of course, but if successful, it demonstrates the conceptual relations between such terms “thinking,” “language,” “private,” “public,” and so on. And it allows Sellars to critique the traditional account of the nature of these.

Importantly, Sellars has inverted the Cartesian order of knowledge discussed above. We saw that for Descartes, the inner is known first, and is the starting point for any knowledge of the outer, the physical world. Sellars has argued, in essence, that our ability to be aware of the inner in fact requires an antecedent command of the language of public states of affairs. A subject must be able to speak of red objects before speaking of red sensations; more generally, a subject must have command of the public language before being able to report on her own inner events. Crucially, though, we have given this account without sacrificing the inner. We can still talk meaningfully about how things are within us (our thoughts and sensations) and we can still have the direct, unmediated knowledge Descartes and others spoke of, but without violating any strictures on the public character of concepts and knowledge. To summarize all this into something tidy, we might say that Cartesians hold the inner to be knowable better and prior to the outer, while Sellars claims just the reverse. We can know and be aware of the inner only by first understanding and knowing the outer. Sellars has flipped the Cartesian picture on its head.

6. The Nature of Thinking and Sensing

Much ground has been covered so far. But students of contemporary analytic philosophy of mind may still find themselves unsatisfied. Though an account has been given that preserves the inner nature of mental episodes, while keeping with certain demands on the nature of knowledge and awareness, one may still find themselves with such questions as: “What, though, are thoughts? What are sensations?” Much of contemporary philosophy has been devoted to these questions, and we have seemingly yet to address them.

We are now, however, in a position to do so. The key lies in the models that were used by Jones in the postulation of his theoretical entities: thoughts and sensations. When it came to the postulation of thoughts, which were posited to explain purposive, intelligent but silent behavior, Jones used overt speech as the model for these thoughts. Thinking is like speaking, he claimed, though of course doesn’t involve a hidden wagging tongue. The important point is that the concepts and categories we use to articulate the nature of thinking are grounded in the semantic concepts and categories appropriate to the characterization of the nature of speaking and writing; in other words, our public language. For it is this public language that is being used to characterize the nature of thinking itself. In particular, it is the semantic properties of linguistic acts that are used to characterize thoughts, not their phonological or graphic properties. (Compare the historical use of macroscopic objects such as billiard balls, plum pudding, rubber bands, springs, and so on as models in the development of the modern conception of the atom. Some features of each of these objects are used for the analogy, and some are not. Protons were said to be hard and round, like a billiard ball, but of course don’t come in stripes and solids).

To answer the question “What is thinking?” therefore requires an answer to the question, “What is language?” since the only understanding we have of the former is going to be parasitic on our understanding of the latter. Here Sellars’ systematic philosophy makes its presence felt again, for Sellars does have an account of the nature of language. Though it warrants an entry on its own, the short answer is that for Sellars, the meaning of linguistic terms is given by the functional role those terms play in inferences, in reasoning. The famous analogy used here is that a word’s meaning is akin to a chess piece, where what makes a particular chess piece the one it is, say a pawn versus a bishop, is what can be done with it, how it can be used. Words, in turn, are used to help make inferences, to reason. The contributing role a word makes to such reasoning gives us its functional role, and thus its meaning. With this as the model, we can now say that thinking is done with “inner elements”, where the functional role these elements play in inferences made in thinking parallels the patterns of use of their public linguistic counterparts. Since what matters is the functional role played by these elements, not by what they are made of (as is the case with chess pieces), Sellars emerges as an early (if not the earliest contemporary) functionalist in the philosophy of mind. Thinking is understood as the counterpart to overt linguistic behavior, which for Sellars means the use of linguistic items in the service of inferences, the meanings of the items given by the role they play in those inferences.

Early in this entry, the issue of intentionality was raised, where this feature was taken to be a sign of the mental. Sellars’ relation to that traditional view is complicated, but the essence of his position can now be stated. In some sense, we are able to talk about things because we have thoughts about things. But in a deep sense, our understanding of those thoughts, and of thinking itself, is dependent upon our ability to understand and use a language. It is unhelpful, therefore, to seek to explain the intentionality of language by appeal to the intentionality of thinking, as is traditionally done. For as we’ve seen, our understanding of thinking itself requires the use of categories and concepts, which in their primary use categorize and explain language itself. In this way, we may say that in the deep sense we can’t think unless we can use a language, though there is another, causal sense, in which we can’t speak unless we can think. That is, our thoughts may cause us to speak, but saying that sheds little light on what thinking is, since our understanding of thinking itself, as seen in the Myth of Jones, requires using language itself as a model. And according to Sellars, the intentionality of language is fundamental, and can be explained by talking about just how language itself works. We need not, in other words, explain how language can be about the world, or how it can represent, by having to smuggle in a more basic layer according to which it is the intentionality of thinking that really does the explanatory work. A fully developed philosophy of language can articulate the intentionality of language in its own right.

While we’ve characterized thoughts and their intentionality in terms of functional role and inferential patterns of reasoning, Sellars’ account of sensations is importantly different. For while what matters in thinking is the function or organization of the elements, not what they are made of, for sensations, it is essential that they have an intrinsic nature and not merely a structure or organization. In this way, Sellars’ theory of sensations, what he calls sense-impressions, resembles what are historically known as sense-data, sensory items that have an intrinsic quality and which can be sensed directly. But the connection with sense-data ends there, at least as sense-data were developed by philosophers in the early parts of the twentieth century. Though Sellars holds sense-impressions to have an intrinsic quality, he seeks to deny them the status of foundationally known items, as we’ve seen, and also to deny their status as particulars or individuals. Instead, sense-impressions are said to be ways a perceiver may be. Sometimes known as an “adverbial analysis,” Sellars aims to show that a sentence such as:

1) Jones has a sensation of a red triangle.

is really to be analyzed and understood as

2) Jones senses-red-triangularly.

where the point of this awkward way of speaking is to illustrate that the only individual or particular that exists is Jones himself. Sense-impression, or sensations, might be thought of as belonging to the metaphysical category of states or conditions. Compare a similar treatment where instead of speaking of a person and an additional unusual object, one that comes and goes out of existence, we might understand the sentence

3) Smith grimaced a frown

to really be saying something metaphysically simpler, requiring only reference to a person and a condition or state they are in:

4) Smith grimaced unhappily.

This element of Sellars’ philosophy is likely the most complicated and controversial, for here Sellars locates his beliefs about the nature of color (color is a sense-impression, for instance), which in turn raises Sellars’ views about the nature of science and the struggle to reconcile our commonsense views of the world with a developing scientific one. Enough has been said so far, however, to bring out the significance of Sellars distinguishing an account of thinking from an account of sensing. As we’ve noted, distinguishing these is a rejection of Descartes, and an acceptance of a crucial theme in Kant’s philosophy. For reasons of length, the tremendous influence of Kant on Sellars’ philosophy has been downplayed, although much of Sellars’ writing is devoted to working out and defending deep, difficult Kantian themes. We’ve also neglected a discussion of the significant influence Sellars himself has had on contemporary philosophy. Contemporary writers such John McDowell, Jerry Fodor, Paul Churchland, and Daniel Dennett have all been influenced in important ways by Sellars’ thinking. That isn’t to say they all agree with him. But the very framework many philosophers work with today has been shaped and molded by Sellars.

In summation, Sellars has a complex philosophy of mind, one that is connected in essential places with his views about knowledge, language, metaphysics, and science. This is not surprising, considering Sellars’ often cited claim about the nature of philosophy itself:

The aim of philosophy, abstractly formulated, is to understand how things in the broadest possible sense of the term hang together in the broadest possible sense of the term. Under “things in the broadest possible sense” I include such radically different items as not only “cabbages and kings,” but numbers and duties, possibilities and finger snaps, aesthetic experience and death. To achieve success in Philosophy would be, to use a contemporary turn of phrase, to “know one’s way around” with respect to all these things, not in that unreflective way in which the centipede of the story knew its way around before it faced the question, “how do I walk?”, but in that reflective way which means that no intellectual holds are barred.

7. References for Further Reading

a. Primary Texts

Sellars, Wilfrid. “Empiricism and the Philosophy of Mind,” in Science, Perception and Reality. (Atascadero: Ridgeview Publishing Co, 1991).
- This paper is a philosophical classic, and is widely held to be one of the most important essays of twentieth century philosophy. It contains Sellars’ discussion of both the Myth of the Given and the Myth of Jones. The essay has been republished in book form, with a helpful study guide, as:
Sellars, Wilfrid. Empiricism and the Philosophy of Mind (Harvard: Harvard University Press, 1997).
Sellars, Wilfrid. “Intentionality and the Mental” (Chisholm-Sellars Correspondence on Intentionality). In Minnesota Studies in the Philosophy of Science, Vol. II, (Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press, 1956). pp 521-539.
- An extended correspondence between Sellars and a defender of a classic conception of mind, as discussed above, on the nature of intentionality. A difficult but important piece of philosophy.
Sellars, Wilfrid. “Mental Events” in Philosophical Studies. vol. 39 (1981), pp.325-45.
Sellars, Wilfrid. Science and Metaphysics: Variations on Kantian Themes (London: Routledge and Kegan Paul, 1968).
Sellars, Wilfrid, “The Structure of Knowledge: (1) Perception; (2) Minds; (3) Epistemic Principles,” in Action, Knowledge, and Reality: Studies in Honor of Wilfrid Sellars. Ed. by H.N. Castaneda. (New York: Bobbs-Merrill, 1975).
- The second portion, on minds, gives a clear statement of Sellars’ views and provides a good overview of the connections between his philosophy of mind and other areas of philosophy. The volume contains a series of critical essays on Sellars’ philosophy as well.

b. Secondary Texts

deVries, Willem A., and Timm Triplett. Knowledge, Mind, and the Given: Reading Wilfrid Sellars’ “Empiricism and the Philosophy of Mind”. (Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing Co., 2000). A book length discussion and commentary of Sellars’, “Empiricism and the Philosophy of Mind”.
- Includes the text of the essay as well.
Delaney, C.F., Michael J. Loux, Gary Gutting, and W. David Solomon. eds. The Synoptic Vision: Essays on the Philosophy of Wilfrid Sellars (Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press, 1977).
- A collection of essays designed to provide overview and introduction to different areas of Sellars’ philosophy.
deVries, Willem A. Wilfrid Sellars. Philosophy Now Series. (London: Acumen Publishing and Montreal: McGill-Queen’s University Press: 2005).
O’Shea, James. Wilfrid Sellars. (London: Routledge Press) Forthcoming.
Pitt, Joseph C., ed., The Philosophy of Wilfrid Sellars: Queries and Extensions. (Dordrecht, Holland: D. Reidel Publishing Co, 1978).
- A collection of critical essays, on various areas of Sellars’ work.
Rosenberg, Jay F. “Wilfrid Sellars’ Philosophy of Mind” in Contemporary Philosophy, 4: Philosophy of Mind, ed. by Guttorm Floistad (1983) pp. 417-39.

Author Information

Eric M. Rubenstein
Email: erubenst@iup.edu
Indiana University of Pennsylvania
U. S. A.

The KK (Knowing that One Knows) Principle

In its simplest form, the KK principle says that, for any proposition p, if one knows that p, then one knows that one knows it. More complex formulations say that if one knows that p, then one is in a position to know that one knows it, and this is fleshed out in a variety of ways. One reason why philosophers are interested in the KK principle is its relevance to the question of whether epistemic logic is a branch of modal logic. An important issue in modal logic is whether necessary truths are necessarily necessary; the corresponding issue in modal epistemic logic is whether the KK principle holds. Another reason for interest in the principle is its relevance to the debate between internalists and externalists about knowledge. It is natural for internalists to endorse something like the KK principle, and for externalists to reject it. A third reason for interest in the KK principle is its connection to the paradox of the Surprise Examination. The reasoning which generates this paradox seems to assume that certain kinds of knowledge can be repeatedly iterated, and hence that something like the KK principle holds. A final reason for studying the principle is its relevance to recent debates about the luminosity of mental states (where a mental state is luminous iff, roughly, one cannot be in that state without being in a position to know that one is in it). If the KK principle holds, then knowledge is a luminous mental state; but there are powerful arguments against the luminosity of other mental states which seem to show that this cannot be the case.

Hintikka on the KK principle
Internalism, Externalism and the KK principle
The Surprise Examination and the KK principle
Williamson’s Anti-Luminosity Argument
Replies to Williamson
References and Further Reading

1. Hintikka on the KK principle

In his 1951, G.H. von Wright suggested that epistemic logic— the logic of the term “knows”— is a branch of modal logic— that is to say, the logic of possibility and necessity. Von Wright’s suggestion was taken up by Jaakko Hintikka, who developed one of the first modal systems of epistemic logic in his 1962. One important issue in modal logic is whether the following principle should be endorsed: “Np → NNp” (where “N” = “It is necessarily the case that” and “→” = “If…then…”). The corresponding issue in modal epistemic logic is whether the following principle should be endorsed: “Kp → KKp” (where “K” = “One knows that”). In chapter 5 of his 1962, Hintikka argues that it should.

Hintikka’s arguments for this “KK principle” are hard to follow; but the gist of them (as clarified in his 1970) seems to be this:

Suppose we say that evidence for a proposition, P, is conclusive iff it is so strong that, once one discovers it, further inquiry cannot give one reason to stop believing P. The concept of knowledge used by many philosophers seems to be a strong one on which one knows P only if one’s evidence for P is conclusive in this sense. It is plausible that the KK principle holds for this strong concept of knowledge. For it is plausible that one’s evidence for P is conclusive in the above sense only if it rules out the possibility that one does not know P, and thus only if it allows one to know that one knows P.

To see this, suppose one has evidence, E, for a proposition P, and that E does not rule out the possibility that one does not know P. If E does not rule out this possibility, then, after one has discovered E, further inquiry can, in principle, reveal to one that one does not know P. But if further inquiry were to reveal this, then it would surely give one reason to stop believing P (since one should not believe things that one does not know). So it is plausible that, if E does not rule out the possibility that one does not know P, then it is not conclusive in the sense just defined, and hence plausible that, if knowledge requires evidence that is conclusive in this sense, the KK principle holds. (cf. Hintikka 1970: 145-6)

As Hintikka stresses in his 1970, the above argument aims only to show that the KK principle holds for a very strong, idealised concept of knowledge, which may be very different from the concept used in everyday discourse. Because of this, Hintikka can sidestep objections which say that the principle conflicts with our everyday knowledge claims. One such objection says that, when the claim is made that someone knows that p, it cannot usually be claimed that they know that they know that p, that they know that they know that they know that p, and so on (cf. Rynin 1967: 29). The fact that one is not prepared to claim these things may show that the KK principle fails for our ordinary concept of knowledge, but it does not show that the principle fails for the strong concept that Hintikka has in mind. Similarly, the objection that the KK principle prevents knowledge from being ascribed to animals and young children (who lack the concept of knowledge and so cannot know that they know) is not problematic for Hintikka. For he can say that, when knowledge is ascribed to such subjects, the everyday concept of knowledge is being used rather than his strong concept.

If the KK principle only holds for a concept of knowledge that is very different from our everyday concept, then why should one be interested in it? According to Hintikka, its interest derives from the fact that (in spite of the differences between our everyday concept and the strong concept) there are “many philosophers, traditional as well as contemporary” who use the strong concept of knowledge for which the principle holds (1970: 148). Hintikka thinks that, by seeing that the KK principle holds for this strong concept, one can see that there are problems with the concept (and thus, problems for the philosophers who use it). He argues for this by appealing to some ideas about the purpose of philosophical and scientific inquiry that are suggested by the work of Karl Popper.

According to these Popperian ideas, philosophers and scientists should always aim to encourage inquiry and discussion; they should never try to bring it to an end. Because of this, they should not employ a concept of knowledge which requires conclusive evidence in Hintikka’s sense. For evidence for P which is conclusive in this sense renders further inquiry into P pointless, and so acts as a “discussion stopper.” And what philosophers and scientists should be aiming for is evidence that encourages further inquiry and discussion, rather than evidence that stops it. (Hintikka 1970: 148-9)

Another problem for the strong concept of knowledge which Hintikka mentions briefly is that the standards that one must meet, in order to satisfy this concept, seem unrealistically high (1970: 149). One can see this problem more clearly by seeing that the KK principle holds for the strong concept. For, as shall be seen in section 3, there is reason to think that each iteration of one’s knowledge requires an improvement in one’s epistemic position. Because of this, the KK principle can seem to imply, implausibly, that one must be in a maximally strong epistemic position in order to know.

2. Internalism, Externalism and the KK principle

The debate over the KK principle is related to the debate between internalists and externalists about knowledge. The connection between the two debates can be illustrated by focusing on some examples of internalist and externalist theories.

A good example of an internalist theory of knowledge is the classical “justified true belief” or JTB theory that was the target of Edmund Gettier’s 1963 article. According to the JTB theory, knowledge is true belief that is based on adequate evidence or reasons, where the adequacy of our evidence or reasons is something that one can determine by introspection and reflection.

A good example of an externalist theory of knowledge is the reliabilist theory defended by Goldman (1979) and others on which knowledge is, roughly, true belief that is produced by a reliable process. The reliability of the processes that produce our beliefs is not something that one can determine by introspection and reflection; it is a matter for empirical investigation.

In general, internalist theories of knowledge say that the property which distinguishes knowledge from mere true belief (which property, following Plantinga 1993a, can be called warrant) is internal to our cognitive perspective. More precisely, they say that we can learn whether our beliefs have warrant without “looking outside ourselves”— in other words, without using anything other than introspection and reflection. Externalist theories say that warrant may be external to our cognitive perspective, and that empirical investigation may be needed to ascertain which of our beliefs have it. The reliabilist theory described is just one example of an externalist theory. Others include the causal theory of knowledge defended by Goldman (1967) and the counterfactual theories defended by Dretske (1971) and Nozick (1981).

It is natural for internalists to endorse something like the KK principle. For knowing that one knows that p is primarily a matter of knowing that one’s belief that p is warranted, and it is natural for internalists to say that one is always in a position to know whether one’s beliefs are warranted. Of course, to know that one knows that p, one must also know that one’s belief that p is true. But it seems clear that anyone who knows that p is in a position to know that their belief that p is true; so it is natural for internalists to endorse the KK principle.

It is also natural for externalists to reject this principle. For, if warrant may be external to our cognitive perspective, then there is no special reason to expect those who know that p to be in a position to know that their belief that p is warranted. This can be seen this more clearly by focusing on the reliabilist theory of knowledge. If one’s belief that p is produced by a reliable process that one knows nothing about, then one may have no way of knowing that this belief constitutes knowledge, and thus no way of knowing that one knows that p.

In light of the above points, it is natural to think that arguments for internalist theories of knowledge support the KK principle, and that arguments for externalist theories threaten it. Arguments for externalist theories are given by Goldman (1967, 1976), Armstrong (1973), Dretske (1971, 1981), Nozick (1981) and Plantinga (1993a and 1993b), and arguments for internalist theories by Chisholm (1966, 1988), Lehrer (1974, 1986) and BonJour (1985). Externalist theories are often motivated by a desire to understand knowledge in terms of scientific concepts, like causation and counterfactual dependence (cf. Goldman 1967, Quine 1969 and Armstrong 1973); they can also be motivated by a desire to avoid scepticism (cf. Nozick 1981). Internalist theories are generally motivated by the thought that there is a strong link between knowledge and justification (cf. Chisholm 1966, Lehrer 1974 and BonJour 1985); they can also be motivated by the related thought that knowledge is an essentially normative property (cf. BonJour 1985, Chisholm 1988 and Kim 1988). Whether these motivations for the two kinds of theory are good ones remains to be seen; but it is useful to see that they have a bearing not just on these theories, but also on the issue of whether the KK principle holds.

However, it is important to realise that, while it is natural for internalists to endorse and externalists to reject the KK principle, it is not necessary for them to do so. Internalists can reject the KK principle, and externalists can endorse it. To see that internalists can reject the KK principle, note that it is possible to adopt a position on which one is not always in a position to know about the internal, mental properties that are normally accessible to introspection and reflection. Timothy Williamson holds a position of this kind; his arguments for it are described in section 4. To see that externalists can endorse the KK principle, note that one can say that the property that externalists identify with warrant— such as being caused in the right way, or being produced by a reliable process— is one that has to be known about in order to have knowledge. Alvin Goldman comes close to adopting a position of this kind in his 1967, when he argues that, in cases of inferential knowledge, a subject must “correctly reconstruct” important elements of the causal chain leading from the fact that p to their belief that p in order to have knowledge.

Overall, it seems clear that, while the internalism/externalism debate is relevant to the KK principle, there are other issues that bear on its status. Some of these issues are described in the next two sections.

3. The Surprise Examination and the KK principle

There are a number of thinkers who hold that the KK principle, or something very like it, plays a crucial role in the Surprise Examination paradox (see Harrison 1969, McLelland and Chihara 1975 and Williamson 1992: 226-32 and 2000:135-146 for examples). Their view is, roughly, that the paradox can be solved by rejecting the principle. In what follows, a brief outline will be given of the paradox and the way in which the principle seems to be related to it. (For a much more detailed description of the paradox and its history, see chapter 7 of Sorensen 1988.)

Suppose that a teacher announces to her pupils that she intends to give them a surprise examination at some point in the following term. The pupils can argue, as follows, that she will not be able to do this:

If you want the exam to be a surprise, then you cannot give it on the last day of term; for if you do, then we will know, on the second-to-last day, that it will be on the last day, and the exam won’t be a surprise. You also cannot give the exam on the second-to-last day of term. For if you do, then we will know, on the third-to-last day, that it will be on either the last day or the second-to-last day, and will know, by the reasoning just described, that it will not be on the last day; so again the exam won’t be a surprise. Parallel reasoning shows that you cannot give the exam on the third-to-last day, or the fourth-to-last day, or on any of the other days of term. Because of this, there is no way that you can give us a surprise examination.

It is natural to think there must be something wrong with the pupils’ reasoning; but it is hard to see where the reasoning goes wrong. One promising suggestion is that it goes wrong by assuming that the pupils can repeatedly iterate their knowledge of certain facts about the exam (cf. Williamson 2000: 140-1). To see that this suggestion is promising, the pupils’ reasoning needs to be divided into parts.

Let part 1 of the pupils’ reasoning be the part that rules out the last day, let part 2 be the part that rules out the second-to-last day, and so on. Since part 2 of the pupils’ reasoning rests on the assumption that part 1 works, it is natural to say that part 2 works only if they know that part 1 works. And since part 3 rests on the assumption that part 2 works, it is natural to say that part 3 works only if they know that part 2 works, and thus, only if they are in a position to know that they know that part 1 works. Similar reasoning seems to show that part 4 works only if they are in a position to know that they know that they know that part 1 works, and so on. So the pupils’ reasoning seems to assume that they are in a position to repeatedly iterate their knowledge of the fact that part 1 works, and it is not at all clear that this assumption is correct.

To see that the assumption is implausible, imagine that the teacher asks the pupils whether they know that part 1 of their reasoning works, and then asks them whether they know that they know this, and so on. It is plausible that, at some stage of this interrogation, the pupils should stop saying “Yes” to the teacher’s questions. For it is plausible that the epistemic standard that the pupils have to meet in order to appropriately say “Yes” goes up with each new question. If someone is asked whether it is the case that p, and when they say “Yes,” they are asked whether they know that it is the case that p, they are generally being asked to check their original assertion against higher standards (cf. DeRose 2002: 184-5).

Because of this, it is plausible that the pupils cannot go on iterating their knowledge of part 1’s success forever. And if that is so, then there is a limit to the number of possible examination days that their reasoning can rule out. If there is such a limit, it can be used to explain why the pupils’ reasoning fails to show that the teacher cannot give them a surprise examination. The explanation is that they cannot iterate their knowledge of part 1’s success enough to rule out every day of the term.

In defense of this explanation, note that the pupils’ reasoning does seem to rule out later days of the term as possible days for the exam. It is very plausible that part 1 of the reasoning rules out the last day of term as a possible date for the exam, and quite plausible that part 2 rules out the second-to-last day. But parts 3 and 4 seem more questionable, and by the time part 10 is gotten to, it is clear that something has gone wrong. The above explanation can account for this gradual loss of power in the pupils’ reasoning, by appealing to the gradual increase in the number of iterations of knowledge required to make the reasoning work (cf. Williamson 2000: 142).

If the failure of the pupils’ reasoning is best explained in terms of limits on their ability to iterate their knowledge, then one seems obliged to say that their knowledge does not satisfy the KK principle. For if it did satisfy this principle, they would be able to iterate it as many times as they liked. The fact that the knowledge of the epistemically limited pupils does not satisfy this principle does not show that there are not other, more idealised kinds of knowledge that do. But it does suggest that the principle fails to hold for our everyday concept of knowledge, and hence that the best strategy for defending it is to follow Hintikka in arguing that it holds only for a strengthened version of this concept.

4. Williamson’s Anti-Luminosity Argument

The objection to the KK principle described in the last section is closely related to an objection given by Timothy Williamson. Williamson’s objection uses the concept of luminosity; for him, a condition, C, is luminous iff the following claim holds:

(L) For every case α, if in α C obtains, then in α one is in a position to know that C obtains (2000: 95).

If the KK principle holds, then the condition of knowing that p is luminous in Williamson’s sense. In chapter 4 of his 2000, Williamson argues that any condition that can be gradually gained or lost is not luminous, and that, since knowing that p is a condition that can be gradually gained or lost, the KK principle fails.

Williamson argues against the luminosity of conditions that can be gradually gained or lost by focusing on the condition of feeling cold, which seems to stand a very good chance of being luminous. His argument is focused on a case in which:

(i) One feels freezing cold at dawn, very slowly warms up and feels hot by noon.

(ii) One is not aware of any change in one’s feelings of hot and cold over 1 millisecond, and:

(iii) Throughout the morning, one thoroughly considers how cold or hot one feels, and so always knows everything that one is in a position to know about this.

Using t₀, t₁… t_n for times at 1 millisecond intervals between dawn and noon, and α_i for the case that holds at t_i (where 0 ≤ i ≤ n), Williamson argues that the following principle holds for all values of i:

(1_i) If in α_i one knows that one feels cold, then in α_i+1 one feels cold.

He does so by appealing to the plausible safety principle that, if one knows that p, then one’s belief that p could not easily have been false. When this principle is formulated in terms of possible cases, it says: one knows that p in case α only if one’s belief that p is true in every possible case that is sufficiently similar to α. Since α_i+1 is extremely similar to α_i for every value of i, it is natural to infer from this principle that (1_i) holds for all such values.

After arguing that (1_i) holds for all such values, Williamson points out that, if feeling cold is luminous, then this principle holds for all values of i:

(2_i) If in α_i one feels cold, then in α_i one knows that one feels cold. (2000: 97)

He then attacks the luminosity of feeling cold by giving a reductio argument against the assumption that (1_i) and (2_i) hold for all values of i. One way of giving this argument (used in Neta and Rohrbaugh 2004) is to note that, by hypothetical syllogism, (2_i) and (1_i) together entail:

(3_i) If in α_i one feels cold, then in α _i+1 one feels cold.

If (1_i) and (2_i) hold for all values of i, then (3_i) also holds for all such values. And if it does, then this principle, which is clearly true:

(4₀) In α₀ one feels cold.

(since α₀ is at dawn and at dawn one is freezing) implies this principle, which is clearly false:

(4_n) In α_n one feels cold.

(since α_n is at noon and at noon one is hot). No true principle can imply a false principle. So (3_i) cannot hold for all values of i, which means that (1_i) and (2_i) cannot hold for all such values. It has been argued that (1_i) holds for all such values; so it seems that (2_i) must fail to hold for some of them. But if feeling cold were luminous then (2_i) would hold for all values of i. So it seems that feeling cold cannot be luminous.

If the above argument shows that the condition of feeling cold is not luminous, then parallel arguments will show the same thing for every condition that can be gradually gained or lost. Since the condition of knowing that p seems to be a condition of this kind, the above argument threatens to show that it is not luminous, and hence that the KK principle fails. But there are ways in which advocates of the KK principle, or of luminosity more generally, can respond to the argument. The next section describes two responses of this kind.

5. Replies to Williamson

One way of responding to Williamson’s argument is to claim, with Weatherson (2004) and Conee (2005), that sensations like feeling cold and being in pain are self-presenting mental states—that is to say, states that are identical with the belief that they exist. If a state is self-presenting, then the belief that it exists satisfies Williamson’s safety constraint; so if feeling cold is self-presenting, then Williamson’s defense of (1_i) fails. However it seems clear that the state of knowing that p is not a self-presenting mental state; for one can believe that one knows that p without actually knowing it. So while this line of response may show that states like feeling cold and being in pain can be luminous, it seems unlikely to save the KK principle (as Weatherson and Conee both grant).

Another way of responding to Williamson’s argument is to claim, with Brueckner and Fiocco (2002) and Neta and Rohrbaugh (2004), that the safety principle to which Williamson appeals is false. This line of response seems more likely to save the KK principle; one way of developing it is to focus on the following example (taken from Neta and Rohrbaugh):

“I am drinking a glass of water which I have just poured from the bottle. Standing next to me is a happy person who has just won the lottery. Had this person lost the lottery, she would have maliciously polluted my water with a tasteless, odorless, colorless toxin. But since she won the lottery, she does no such thing. Nonetheless, she almost lost the lottery. Now, I drink the pure, unadulterated water, and judge, truly and knowingly, that I am drinking pure, unadulterated water. But the toxin would not have flavored the water, and so had the toxin gone in, I would still have believed falsely that I was drinking pure, unadulterated water. The actual case and the envisaged possible case are extremely similar in all past and present phenomenological and physical respects, as well as nomologically indistinguishable. (Furthermore, we can stipulate that, in each case, I am killed by a sniper a few minutes after drinking the water, and so the cases do not differ in future respects.)” [Neta and Rohrbaugh 2004: 400]

It seems clear that, in this example, I know that I am drinking unadulterated water, despite the fact that there is a very similar possible case in which I falsely believe that I am drinking such water. So the example conflicts with the safety principle’s claim that beliefs constitute knowledge only if they are true in all sufficiently similar cases.

Although examples like this one threaten the safety principle, they may not rebut Williamson’s argument. For the key premise of the argument— that (1_i) is true for all values of i— can be defended in other ways. To see this, consider the following claim, which is the contrapositive of (1_i):

(1_i‘) If in α_i+1 one does not feel cold, then in α_i one does not know that one feels cold.

It is plausible independently of the safety principle that (1_i‘), and thus (1_i), holds for all values of i. For if one does not feel cold in α_i+1 and one is not aware of any change in ones feelings of hot and cold between α_i and α_i+1, then how could one possibly know that in α_i one feels cold?

Even if it turns out that (1_i) cannot be adequately defended, it may still turn out that the KK principle is rebutted by reasoning like Williamson’s. For it is possible to give an argument against the KK principle which closely resembles the anti-luminosity argument described above, but which does not appeal to (1_i). This argument focuses on cases of inexact knowledge— that is to say, of the sort of knowledge that one gains by looking at a distant tree and estimating its height, or by looking at a crowd and estimating the number of people that it contains. In chapter 5 of his 2000, Williamson argues that such knowledge satisfies margin for error principles like the following:

(M₁) If I know that the tree is not n inches tall, then it is not n+1 inches tall.

(M₂) If I know that there are not n people in the crowd, then there are not n+1 people in the crowd.

He then shows that, when principles of this kind are conjoined with a plausible closure principle on knowledge, they are incompatible with the KK principle.

Although Williamson’s arguments against the KK principle are powerful, they can be resisted at a price. For, in all of their forms, they assume that some true beliefs constitute knowledge (such as a freezing cold person’s belief that they feel cold) and that others do not (such as an accidentally true belief that a 600-inch-tall distant tree is not 599 inches tall). The first of these assumptions can be denied by endorsing a skeptical theory on which no true belief constitutes knowledge and the second can be denied by endorsing a “universalist” theory on which every true belief constitutes knowledge. Although both theories have implausible consequences, recent work (such as Goldman 2002: 164 on weak senses of knowledge and Hawthorne 2004: 113-141 on skepticism) has revealed that both have attractive features. If the benefits of these theories outweigh their costs, then Williamson’s arguments against the KK principle may still fail. In any case, it seems fair to conclude that the KK principle, and the arguments for and against it, remain important subjects of philosophical debate.

6. References and Further Reading

Armstrong, D.M. 1973. Belief, Truth and Knowledge. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
BonJour, L. 1985. The Structure of Empirical Knowledge. Cambridge, Mass.: Harvard University Press.
Brueckner, A. and Fiocco, M.O. 2002. “Williamson’s Anti-Luminosity Argument,” Philosophical Studies 110: 285-293.
Castaneda, H.N. 1970. “On Knowing (Or Believing) That One Knows (Or Believes),” Synthese 21: 187-203.
Chisholm, R. 1966. Theory of Knowledge. Englewood Cliffs: Prentice-Hall.
Chisholm, R. 1988. “The Indispensability of Internal Justification,” Synthese 74: 285-96.
Conee, E. 2005. “The Comforts of Home,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 70: 444-451.
Craig, E.J. 1990. Knowledge and the State of Nature. Oxford: Clarenden Press.
Danto, A.C. 1967. “On Knowing That We Know,” in A. Stroll ed., Epistemology, New York: Harper and Rowe, pp.32-53.
DeRose, K. 2002. “Assertion, Knowledge and Context,” Philosophical Review 111: 167-203.
Dretske, F. 1971. “Conclusive Reasons,” Australasian Journal of Philosophy, 49: 1-22.
Dretske 1981. Knowledge and the Flow of Information. Oxford: Blackwell.
Gettier, E. 1963. “Is Justified True Belief Knowledge?” Analysis 23: 121-3.
Ginet, C. 1970. “What Must Be Added to Knowing to Obtain Knowing that One Knows?” Synthese 21: 163-86.
Goldman 1967. “A Causal Theory of Knowing,” Journal of Philosophy 64: 357-72.
Goldman 1976. “Discrimination and Perceptual Knowledge,” Journal of Philosophy 73: 771-91.
Goldman 1979. “What is Justified Belief?” In Justification and Knowledge: New Studies in Epistemology, ed. George Pappas (Dordrecth, D. Reidel, 1979).
Goldman 2002. Pathways to Knowledge. New York: Oxford.
Harrison, C, 1969. “The Unanticipated Examination in View of Kripke’s Semantics for Modal Logic,” In J.W. Davies, D.J. Hockney and W.K Wilson eds, Philosophical Logic (Dordrecht: Reidel).
Hawthorne, J. 2004. Knowledge and Lotteries. New York: Oxford University Press.
Hintikka, J. 1962. Knowledge and Belief. Ithaca, N.Y.: Cornell University Press.
Hintikka, J. 1970. “Knowing that One Knows” reviewed. Synthese 21: 141-62.
Kim, J. 1988. “What is Naturalized Epistemology?” in J.E. Tomberlin ed., Philosophical Perspectives 2: Epistemology (Atascadero/CA: Ridgeview Publishing Co.), pp.381-405.
Lehrer 1970. “Believing that One Knows,” Synthese 21: 133-40.
Lehrer 1974. Knowledge. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
Lehrer 1985. “The Coherence Theory of Knowledge,” Philosophical Topics 14: 5-25.
Lemmon, E.J. 1967. “If I Know, Do I Know that I Know?” in A. Stroll ed., Epistemology, New York: Harper and Rowe, pp.54-83.
McLelland, J. and Chihara, C. 1975. “The Surprise Examination Paradox,” Journal of Philosophical Logic 4: 71-89.
Neta, R. and Rohrbaugh, G. 2004. “Luminosity and the Safety of Knowledge,” Pacific Philosophical Quarterly 85: 396-406.
Nozick, R. 1981. Philosophical Explanations. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Plantinga, A. 1993a. Warrant: The Current Debate. New York: Oxford University Press.
Plantinga, A. 1993b. Warrant and Proper Function. New York: Oxford University Press.
Quine, W.V.O. 1969. “Epistemology Naturalized,” in his Ontological Relativity and Other Essays. New York: Columbia University Press.
Rynin, D. 1967. “Knowledge, Sensation and Certainty,” in A. Stroll ed., Epistemology, New York: Harper and Rowe, pp.8-32.
Sorensen, R.A. 1988. Blindspots. New York: Oxford University Press.
Unger, P. 1975. Ignorance: A Case for Scepticism. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Von Wright, G. 1951. An Essay in Modal Logic. Amsterdam: North-Holland Publishing Co.
Weatherson, B. 2004. “Luminous Margins,” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 82: 373-83.
Williamson, T. 1992. “Inexact Knowledge,” Mind, 101: 217-42.
Williamson, T. 2000. Knowledge and its Limits. New York: Oxford University Press.

Author Information

David Hemp
Email: david_hemp@hotmail.com
Ireland

Coherentism in Epistemology

Coherentism is a theory of epistemic justification. It implies that for a belief to be justified it must belong to a coherent system of beliefs. For a system of beliefs to be coherent, the beliefs that make up that system must “cohere” with one another. Typically, this coherence is taken to involve three components: logical consistency, explanatory relations, and various inductive (non-explanatory) relations. Rival versions of coherentism spell out these relations in different ways. They also differ on the exact role of coherence in justifying beliefs: in some versions, coherence is necessary and sufficient for justification, but in others it is only necessary.

This article reviews coherentism’s history beginning in the last quarter of the twentieth century, and it marks off coherentism from other theses. The regress argument is the dominant anti-coherentist argument, and it bears on whether coherentism or its chief rival, foundationalism, is correct. Several coherentist responses to this argument will be examined. A taxonomy of the many versions of coherentism is presented and followed by the main arguments for and against coherentism. After these arguments, which make up the main body of the article, a final section considers the future prospects of coherentism.

Introduction
1. History
2. Describing Coherentism
The Regress Argument
1. The Argument
2. Coherentist Responses
Taxonomy of Coherentist Positions
1. What is it to Belong to a Belief System?
2. What is the Makeup of the Coherence Relation?
Arguments for Coherentism
Arguments Against Coherentism
Looking Ahead
References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

a. History

British Idealists such as F.H. Bradley (1846-1924) and Bernard Bosanquet (1848-1923) championed coherentism. So, too, did the philosophers of science Otto Neurath (1882-1945), Carl Hempel (1905-1997), and W.V. Quine (1908-2000). However, it is a group of contemporary epistemologists that has done the most to develop and defend coherentism: most notably Laurence BonJour in The Structure of Empirical Knowledge (1985) and Keith Lehrer in Knowledge (1974) and Theory of Knowledge (1990), but also Gilbert Harman, William Lycan, Nicholas Rescher, and Wilfrid Sellars. Despite this long list of names, coherentism is a minority position among epistemologists. It is probably only in moral epistemology that coherentism enjoys wide acceptance. Under the influence of a prominent interpretation of John Rawls’s model of wide reflective equilibrium, many moral philosophers have opted for a coherentist view of what justifies moral beliefs.

b. Describing Coherentism

Epistemological coherentism (or simply “coherentism”) needs to be distinguished from several other theses. Because it is not a theory of truth, coherentism is not the coherence theory of truth. That theory says that a proposition is true just in case it coheres with a set of propositions. This theory of truth has fallen out of favor in large part because it is thought to be too permissive – an obviously false proposition such as I am a coffee cup coheres with this set of propositions: I am not a human, I am in the kitchen cupboard, I weigh 7 ounces. Even contemporary defenders of coherentism are usually quick to distance themselves from this theory of truth.

Coherentism is also distinct from a thesis about concepts that sometimes goes under the name “concept holism.” Roughly, this thesis says that possessing a particular concept requires possessing a number of other concepts: for example, possessing the concept of assassination requires also having the concepts of killing and death. Concepts, according to the thesis of holism, do not come individually, but in packages. What is crucial here is that neither concept holism nor the coherence theory of truth say anything about the conditions under which a belief is justified.

So exactly what does coherentism have to say regarding when our beliefs are justified? The strongest form of coherentism says that belonging to a coherent system of beliefs is

necessary for a belief to be justified and
by itself sufficient for a belief to be justified.

This view—call it strong coherentism—can be contrasted with two weaker varieties of coherentism. Necessity coherentism just makes the necessity claim at (1). It imposes coherence as what is often called “a structural condition” on justification. Structural conditions just tell us how beliefs must be related to one another if they are to be justified. However, being related to one another in the required way may not suffice for justification, since there might be additional non-structural conditions on justified belief. A particularly lucid statement of necessity coherentism can be found in the 1992 paper by Kvanvig and Riggs. By contrast, strong coherentism can be thought of as denying that there are any non-structural conditions.

When thinking about strong coherentism, it is important to appreciate the by itself qualification in (2). This qualification sets coherentism off from one of its most important rivals. The rival view is typically classified as non-coherentist, but it still gives coherence a supplemental role in justifying beliefs. This view claims that coherence can boost the justification of a belief as long as that belief is already independently justified in some way that is not due to coherence. On this sort of view, coherence is sufficient to boost beliefs that are independently justified. This, however, is not thought to be strong enough to deserve the “coherentist” label. To make coherence sufficient for justification in a way that deserves the label, one must claim that coherence is sufficient, by itself, to generate justification – in other words, coherence must generate justification from scratch. Call this sufficiency coherentism. Notice, also, that sufficiency coherentism allows other factors besides coherence to be sufficient for justification.

Another role that non-coherentists sometimes give to coherence comes in a negative condition on epistemic justification. This condition says that incoherent beliefs fail to be justified. It might seem that on this view, coherence is necessary for justification. But this only follows if coherence and incoherence are contradictories. Below, we will see reasons to think that they are not contradictories, but instead contraries. This explains why a view that says that incoherence disqualifies beliefs from being justified is not classified as a coherentist view. More is required to get the claim that coherence is necessary for justification.

There are real difficulties for circumscribing self-styled coherentists. Not every self-styled coherentist subscribes to either (1) or (2). For example, BonJour, in his 1985 book, held that meeting the coherence condition is not sufficient for justification, since he claimed that, in addition, justified beliefs must meet a distinctive internalist condition. Moreover, since BonJour also held (and still holds) that coherence is not necessary for the justification of a priori beliefs, strictly speaking he did not hold that coherence is necessary for epistemic justification either. Still his early view should be classified as coherentist, since he claimed that coherence is a necessary condition on a wide class of beliefs’ being justified, namely empirical beliefs.

In what follows, each argument for coherentism will be classified according to whether it aims to show necessity coherentism, or sufficiency coherentism (this will also cover arguments for strong coherentism, since it is simply the conjunction of necessity coherentism and sufficiency coherentism). Similarly, each argument against coherentism will be classified according to whether it targets necessity coherentism, or sufficiency coherentism (since an argument that targets either of these views is also an argument against strong coherentism, this will cover arguments against strong coherentism). Following BonJour and much of the recent literature, the focus will be on our empirical beliefs and whether there is a coherence condition on the justification of these beliefs.

One more preliminary point is in order. Since necessity coherentism just makes a claim about the structure that our justified beliefs must take, it is neutral on whether coherence must be introspectively accessible if it is to function as a justifier. In other words, it is neutral on the debate between epistemic internalism and epistemic externalism. So while the most important recent coherentists – namely Laurence BonJour (1985) and Keith Lehrer (1974 and 1990) – have also espoused epistemological internalism, this commitment is over and above that of structural coherentism. This makes their views incompatible with strong coherentism, since the internalist commitment is an additional condition over and above that of structural coherentism.

2. The Regress Argument

The Regress Argument goes back at least as far as Aristotle’s Prior Analytics, Book 1. Like many others, Aristotle takes it to support coherentism’s chief rival, foundationalism. The argument has two stages: one that identifies all of the candidate structural conditions; and one that rules against the coherentist candidate.

a. The Argument

The argument opens with the claim that some of a person’s justified beliefs are justified because they derive their justification from other beliefs. For example, take my justified belief that tomorrow is Wednesday. That belief is justified by two other beliefs: my belief that today is Tuesday and my belief that Tuesday is immediately followed by Wednesday. But, if my belief that tomorrow is Wednesday derives its justification from these other beliefs, then my belief that tomorrow is Wednesday is justified only if these other beliefs are justified. Consider these other beliefs. One possibility is that they derive their justification from yet further beliefs, in which case they are dependent for their justification on those further beliefs – if it is, we can shift our attention to these further beliefs. The other possibility is that these beliefs are justified, but their justification does not derive from some other justified beliefs.

Three options emerge. According to the foundationalist option, the series of beliefs terminates with special justified beliefs called “basic beliefs”: these beliefs do not owe their justification to any other beliefs from which they are inferred. According to the infinitist option, the series of relations wherein one belief derives its justification from one or more other beliefs goes on without either terminating or circling back on itself. According to one construal of the coherentist option, the series of beliefs does circle back on itself, so that it includes, once again, previous beliefs in the series.

Standard presentations of the Regress Argument are used to establish foundationalism; to this end, they include further arguments against the infinitist and coherentist options. These arguments are the focus of the second stage. Let’s focus on the two most popular arguments against coherentism which figure into the Regress Argument; and let’s continue to construe coherentism as saying that beliefs are justified in virtue of forming a circle. The first argument makes a circularity charge. By opting for a closed loop, the charge is that coherentism certifies circular reasoning. A necessity coherentist will be charged with making circular reasoning necessary for justified belief. A sufficiency coherentist will be charged with making circular reasoning part of something (namely, coherence) that is sufficient for justified belief. But circular reasoning is an epistemic flaw, not an epistemic virtue. It is neither necessary, nor part of what is sufficient, for justified belief; in fact, it precludes justified belief.

The second argument takes aim at the claim that coherence is necessary for justification. Since a belief is justified only if, through a chain of other beliefs, we ultimately return to the original belief, coherentism is committed, despite the initial appearance, to the claim that the original belief is justified, at least in part, by itself. This is supposed to follow from the coherentist corollary that if the chain of supporting beliefs did not eventually double back on the original belief, then the original belief would not be justified. But the claim that my belief that tomorrow is Wednesday is justified (even in part) by itself is mistaken – after all, it is derived, via inference, from other beliefs. Call this, the self-support charge.

b. Coherentist Responses

Coherentists need not resist the first stage of the regress argument since that stage, recall, just generated the candidate views. Their responses focus on the second stage. That coherentism is the best of the three candidates is argued for in several ways: by highlighting shortcomings with infinitism and foundationalism, by giving positive arguments for coherentism (we will look at these later in Section 4), and by responding to objections against coherentism. Let’s continue with the two objections that have already been tabled, the circularity and self-support objections, and examine some coherentist responses to these objections.

Some coherentists have responded to the circularity charge by suggesting that reasoning in a circle is not a problem as long as the circle is large enough. This suggestion has not found much favor. What is worrisome about circular reasoning, for example, that it is overly permissive since it allows one to easily construct reasons for any claim whatsoever, applies just as well to large circles of beliefs.

According to a more instructive reply, the circularity charge and the self-support charge rest on a misconception about coherentism. Often coherentists point out that their view is that systems of beliefs are what is, in the first place, justified (or unjustified). Individual beliefs are not the items that are primarily justified (or unjustified). Put in this light, the whole approach of the regress argument is question begging. For notice the argument had us begin with an individual belief that was justified, though conditionally so. Then we went in search of what justifies that belief. This “linear” approach to justification led to the circularity and self-support charges. Coherentism, however, proposes a “holistic” view of justification. On this kind of view, the primary bearer of epistemic justification is a system of beliefs. Seen in this light, both charges seem to be question begging.

Some have argued that the move to holistic justification fails to really answer the circularity and self-support charges. For even granting that it is a system of beliefs that is primarily justified, it is still true that a system of beliefs is justified in virtue of the fact that the individual beliefs that make up the system relate to one another in a circular fashion. And it is still true that a belief must support itself if it is to be justified, since this is needed if the relevant system of beliefs (and hence the individual belief) is to be justified. It is not so clear, then, that the reply which highlights the holistic nature of justification is successful.

However, by conjoining the appeal to epistemic holism with another appeal, a coherentist might have a fully satisfactory reply. This second appeal identifies another misconception about coherentism that might lie behind the circularity charge and the self-support charge. This misconception has to do with the variety of ways in which our beliefs can support one another so that they come out justified. Coherentists are fond of metaphors like rafts, webs, and bricks in an arch. These things stay together because their parts support one another. Each part both supports, and is supported by, other specific parts. So too with justified beliefs: each is both supported by, and supports, other beliefs. This means that among support relations, there are symmetrical support relations: one belief can support a second (perhaps mediately through other beliefs), while the second also supports the first (again, perhaps, mediately). Beliefs that stand in sufficiently strong support relations to one another are coherent, and therefore justified.

This contrasts with foundationalism’s trademark bifurcation of beliefs into basic beliefs and non-basic beliefs. Basic beliefs do the supporting; non-basic beliefs are what they support. According to foundationalists, there are no symmetrical support relations. This much is clear enough. The delicate issue that it raises is this: do the circularity and self-support charges rest on an assumption that beliefs cannot be justified in virtue of standing in symmetrical support relations to one another? If the charges require this assumption, then they might beg the question.

Consider the circularity charge first. To simply assert that circular reasoning is epistemically defective and therefore cannot generate justified beliefs seems very close to simply asserting that beliefs cannot be justified in virtue of standing in symmetrical support relations. What the opponent of coherentism must do is tell us more precisely why circular reasoning is epistemically defective. While the considerations they call on might well imply that symmetrical support relations do not justify, they will be ineffective if they simply assume this.

We are now in a position to see that the self-support charge is importantly different from the circularity charge. Where the circularity charge targets the coherentist claim that beliefs are justified by standing in support relations that are mediated by other beliefs but ultimately return to themselves, the self-support charge focuses on an alleged implication of this, namely that beliefs are therefore justified at least in part because they stand in support relations to themselves. In slogan form: reflexive relations justify.

So what about the self-support charge? Does making this charge require assuming that symmetrical support relations cannot justify? We need to be careful. While the claim that the support relation is transitive and the claim that supporting relations link back to a previously linked belief implies that the relevant belief supports itself, coherentists are not thereby stuck with the claim that this belief is justified in virtue of supporting itself. Arguably, it is open to the coherentist to hold, instead, that this belief is justified in virtue of the circular structure of the support relations, while denying that it is justified in virtue of supporting itself. Still, this may not be enough, since the coherentist might still have to maintain that justified belief is compatible with self-support.

3. Taxonomy of Coherentist Positions

Recall that strong coherentism says S’s belief that p is justified if and only if it belongs, and coheres with, a system of S’s beliefs, and this system is coherent. Central to this formulation are three notions: the notion of a system of beliefs, the notion of belonging to a system of beliefs, and the notion of a coherent system of beliefs. Let’s look at these in order. As we will see, each can be spelled out in different ways. The result is that coherentism covers a wide variety of views.

a. What is it to Belong to a Belief System?

What qualifies a set of beliefs as a system of beliefs? Partly, it is the number of beliefs that make it up. Minimally, a system of beliefs must consist in at least two beliefs. In a moment, we will see that two is probably not enough. The other extreme – that the size of the relevant system is one’s entire corpus of beliefs – must be rejected, on the grounds that any sufficiently strong incoherence would make all of one’s beliefs unjustified. This is implausible, since incoherence in one’s outlook on one topic, say set theory, should not affect the epistemic status of one’s outlook on an unconnected topic, say whether one is presently in pain. Between these two extremes lie a number of importantly different intermediate positions. There are a few general approaches to carving out distinct systems of beliefs in a belief corpus. Let’s look at four.

One way of individuating systems of beliefs is by reference to their subject-matters. For example, your beliefs about mathematical matters might form one system of beliefs, while your beliefs about tonight’s dinner might form another. Alternatively, systems of beliefs might be individuated by the sources that produced them: visual beliefs might form one system, auditory beliefs another, memorial beliefs another, and so forth. The third possibility involves individuating systems phenomenologically. Beliefs themselves, or perhaps key episodes that come with acquiring them, might have phenomenological markers. If these markers stand in similarity relations to one another, this would lead to grouping beliefs into distinct systems. A final possibility, perhaps the most plausible one, involves individuating systems of beliefs according to whether the beliefs that belong to a particular system stand in some dependency relations of a psychological sort to one another – for example, a psychological relation like that involved in inference. We will return to this fourth possibility below.

Let’s turn to the second notion, that of belonging to a system of beliefs. According to straightforward accounts of this notion, for a belief to belong to a system of beliefs, it must relate to the beliefs that make up that system in just the same way that the beliefs relate to one another if they are to constitute a system of beliefs. This will involve one of the four possibilities that were just surveyed.

b. What is the Makeup of the Coherence Relation?

Coherence relations can hold among a set of beliefs that constitute a system. Arguably, coherence relations can also hold between systems of beliefs. On the simplest view, the latter occurs when the individual beliefs that are members of the respective systems cohere with one another across systems. As a result, the beliefs belonging to the respective systems gain in justification. Here, I will focus on the easier case in which a set of beliefs constitute a single coherent system of beliefs.

A coherent system of beliefs has two basic marks. First, the beliefs have to have propositional contents which relate to one another in some specified way. Call this the propositional relation. Additionally, it is plausible to think that the relevant beliefs must be related to one another in one’s psychology in some way, for example by being inferred from one another. Let’s look at the specifics, starting with the propositional relation.

i. The Propositional Relation: Deductive Relations

We need to consider two relations from deductive logic: logical consistency and mutual derivability. At a minimum, coherence requires logical consistency. So a set of belief contents, p1, …. pn, is coherent only if p1, …. pn neither includes, nor logically entails, a contradiction. Logical consistency is far from sufficient, though, since a set of beliefs in a scattered array of propositions can be logically consistent without being justified. Consider, for example, my belief that Joan is sitting, my belief that 2+2=4, and my belief that tomorrow is Wednesday. While these beliefs are logically consistent with one another, more needs to be in place if they are to be justified.

This last set of beliefs illustrates another important point. While coherentists will claim that this set of beliefs does not exhibit coherence, it is at the same time implausible to claim that this set is incoherent. It is not incoherent, since no one of the beliefs is in direct conflict with, that is, contradicts, any of the others. It follows that coherence and incoherence are contraries, not contradictories. If a set of beliefs is coherent, then it is not incoherent; if a set of beliefs is incoherent, then it is not coherent; but as this last case illustrates, there are sets of beliefs that fail to be coherent, but are not incoherent either. The fact that coherence and incoherence are contraries explains the earlier point about why deeming incoherent beliefs unjustified is not enough to make one a coherentist. Just because a theory disqualifies incoherent beliefs from being justified, it is not thereby committed to holding that coherence is necessary for justification.

Consider, next, mutual derivability. Though it is plausible that logical consistency is necessary for coherence, it is too much to require that each believed proposition entail each of the other believed propositions in the system. In fact, it is even too much to require that each believed proposition entail at least one of the other believed propositions. To see why these requirements are too strong, consider these four beliefs: the belief that Moe is wincing, the belief that Moe is squealing, the belief that Moe is yelling “that hurts”, and the belief that Moe is in pain. None of these beliefs logically implies any of the others. Nor does the conjunction of any three of them imply the fourth. Despite the lack of entailments, though, the beliefs together seem to constitute a system of beliefs that is intuitively quite coherent. So coherence can be earned by relations weaker than entailment.

ii. The Propositional Relation: Inductive Relations

Many coherentists have required, in addition to logical consistency, probabilistic consistency. So if one believes that p is 0.9 likely to be true, then one would be required to believe that not-p is 0.1 likely to be true. Here probability assignments appear in the content of what is believed. Alternatively, a theory of probability might generate consistency constraints by imposing constraints on the degrees of confidence with which we believe things. So take a person who believes p, but is not fully confident that p is correct; she believes p to a degree of 0.9. Here 0.9 is not part of the content of what she believes; it measures her confidence in believing p. Consistency might then require that she believe not-p to a degree of 0.1. In one of these two ways, the axioms of probability might help set coherence constraints.

Besides being probabilistically consistent with one another, coherent beliefs gain in justification from being inferred from one another in conformity with the canons of cogent inductive reasoning. Foundationalists, at least moderate foundationalists, have just as much at stake in the project of identifying these canons. It is common to identify distinct branches of inductive reasoning, each with their own respective canons: for example, inference to the best explanation, enumerative induction, and various forms of statistical reasoning. For present purposes, what is crucial in all of this is that beliefs inferred from one another in conformity with the identified canons (whatever the exact canons are) boost coherence, and therefore justification.

iii. The Propositional Relation: Explanatory Relations

To supplement the requirements of logical, and probabilistic, consistency, coherentists often introduce explanatory relations. This allows them to concur that the system consisting in the beliefs that Moe is wincing, Moe is squealing, and Moe is yelling “that hurts” coheres with the belief that Moe is in pain. In addition, it allows us to disqualify the set consisting in my beliefs that Joan is sitting, 2+2=4, and tomorrow is Wednesday on the grounds that these propositions do not in any way explain one another.

There are two ways that a proposition can be involved in an explanatory relation: as being what is explained, or as being what does the explaining. These are not exclusive. The fact there are toxic fumes in the room is explained by the fact that the cap is off the bottle of toxic liquid. The fact that there are toxic fumes in the room, in turn, explains the fact that I am feeling sick. So I might believe that I am feeling sick, draw an explanatory inference and believe that there must be toxic fumes in the air, and then from that belief draw a second explanatory inference and believe that the cap must be off the bottle. In this case, that there are toxic fumes in the air serves to both explain why I am sick and in turn serves as the explanatory basis for the cap being off the bottle. Often what drives coherentists to think that a coherent set of beliefs must consist in more than two beliefs is that the needed explanatory richness requires more than two beliefs.

Disagreement enters when coherentists say exactly what makes one thing a good explanation of another. Among the determinants of good explanation are predictive power, simplicity, fit with other claims that one is justified in believing, and fecundity in answering questions. The nature and relative weight of these, and other, determinants is quite controversial. At this level of detail, coherentists, even so-called explanationists who stress the central played by explanatory considerations, frequently diverge.

Not all coherentists include explanatory relations among the determinants of coherence. See Lehrer (1990) for example. Those that do include them usually give one of two kinds of accounts for why believed propositions that do a good job of explaining one another increase coherence and hence boost justification. One kind of account claims that when beliefs do this, they make each other more likely to be true. On this kind of account, explanatory relations are construed as ultimately being inductive probabilifying relations. On an alterative account, explanatory relations are irreducible ingredients of coherence, ingredients that are simply obvious parts of what contributes to coherence.

iv. The Psychological Realization Condition

It is not enough that the contents of a person’s beliefs happen to cohere with one another. Another condition is needed. In the cognizer’s mind, these beliefs must stand in some relation to one another. This extra condition might be incorporated into an account of a belief system. Let’s consider another way of incorporating the condition. Suppose some coherentist elects to individuate belief systems by the subject-matter of the belief contents. Such a coherentist might then introduce a distinct psychological realization condition, one that figures into an account of the coherence relation rather than into an account of a system of beliefs. If the beliefs in some system are to cohere with one another, they must interact with one another – for example, by being inferred from one another.

On the inferential approach a belief coheres with the rest of the beliefs in some system of beliefs only if it stands in one of two inferential relations to beliefs in that system of beliefs: it might be inferred from one, or more, beliefs in the system; or, it might be a belief from which one, or more, beliefs in the system have been inferred.

But inference is just one option. Arguably, another option would be to impose a counterfactual condition. Roughly, this kind of condition says that a belief coheres with other beliefs in the system to which it belongs only if the following counterfactual conditional claim is true: if the rest of the system were markedly different, in some specified way, then the person would not hold that belief.

4. Arguments for Coherentism

Let’s now survey some of the main arguments for, and against, coherentism. This section reviews four arguments for coherentism. The first attempts to show that coherence is sufficient for justification. Three more attempt to show that it is necessary.

a. For Sufficiency: The Argument from Increased Probability

In An Analysis of Knowledge and Valuation, C.I. Lewis (1883-1964) introduced a case that has been widely discussed. A number of witnesses report the same thing about some event – for example, that Nancy was at last night’s party. However, the witnesses are unreliable about this sort of thing. Moreover, their reports are made completely independently of one another – in other words, the report of any one witness was in no way influenced by the report of any of the other witnesses. According to Lewis, the “congruence of the reports establishes a high probability of what they agree upon.” (p. 246) The point is meant to generalize: whenever a number of unreliable sources operate independently of one another, and they converge with the same finding, this boosts the probability that that finding is correct. This is so regardless of whether the sources are individual testifiers, various sensory modalities, or any combination of sources. Items that individually are quite unreliable and would not justify belief, when taken together under conditions of independent operation and convergence, produce justified beliefs.

This argument has been charged with several shortcomings. For one, it is not clear that the argument, even if sound, establishes coherentism. The argument appears to rest on an inference to the best explanation, one that can be construed along foundationalist lines. So, for each source, S1 . . . Sn, I am justified in believing S1 reports p, S2 reports p . . . Sn reports p. According to foundationalists, these beliefs are justified without being inferred from any other beliefs; they are basic beliefs. Then, inferring to the best explanation, I come to believe p. This belief-that-p is a non-basic belief, but since it rests on basic beliefs, the overall picture is a foundationalist one, not a coherentist one.

Second, even on standard coherence views, it is not clear that the reports-that-p cohere with one another. Logical coherence, both in the sense of logical consistency and in the sense of mutual derivability, is in place; but the explanatory relations that coherentists so often emphasize are not.

Third, it is controversial whether the argument is cogent. One issue here concerns whether each source, taken individually, provides justification for believing p. If each independently confers some justification, then one of coherentism’s rivals – namely, a version of foundationalism which says that coherence can boost overall justification, but cannot generate justification from scratch – can agree. On the other hand, if each source fails on its own to confer any justification whatsoever, then the question remains: does this kind of case show that coherence can create justification from scratch? If the argument is to establish that coherence is by itself sufficient to generate justification, we need to take each individual source as, on its own, providing no justification whatsoever for believing p. Recently Bayesian proofs have been offered to show that the convergence of such sources does not increase the probability of p (see Huemer 1997 and Olson 2005). Their convergence would have been just as likely had p been false.

b. For Necessity: Only Beliefs can Justify Other Beliefs

The next coherentist argument traces to work by Wilfrid Sellars (1973) and Donald Davidson (1986). Often this argument is put forth as an anti-foundationalist argument. However, if successful, it establishes the stronger positive claim of necessity coherentism. According to this argument, only beliefs are suited to justify beliefs. As Davidson puts it, “nothing can count as a reason for holding a belief except another belief” (1986, p.126). Consider the obvious alternative – what justifies our empirical beliefs about the external world are perceptual states. But perceptual states are either states that have propositions as their objects, or they don’t. If they have propositions as their objects, then we need to be aware of these propositions in the sense that we need to believe these propositions in order for the initial belief to be justified. But it is these further beliefs that are really doing the justifying. On the other hand, if they do not have propositions as objects, then, no logical relations can hold between their objects and the propositional contents of the beliefs that they are supposed to justify. That seems to leave perceptual states standing in only causal relations to the relevant empirical beliefs. But, Davidson claims, the mere fact that a belief is caused by a perceptual state implies nothing about whether that belief is justified.

Foundationalists have replied in a number of ways. First, suppose perceptual states do not take propositions as their objects. It is not clear why there needs to be a logical relation between the objects of perceptual states, and the contents of the beliefs that they are supposed to justify. Non-perceptual states can figure into statements of conditional probability, so that on their obtaining, a given belief is likely to be true to some degree or other. Alternatively, they can bear explanatory relations to the beliefs that they are alleged to justify. Second, suppose the relevant perceptual states do take propositions as their objects. It is not at all obvious that one needs to be aware of them for them to justify, though perhaps one does need to be aware of them if one is to show that one’s belief is justified. Here, the coherentist argument is often charged with conflating the notion of a justified belief with the notion of being in a position to show that one’s belief is justified.

c. For Necessity: The Need for Justified Background Beliefs

Coherentists sometimes argue in the following way. First, they invoke a prosaic justified belief about the external world – say my present belief that there is a computer in front of me. Then they claim that this belief is justified only if I am justified in believing that the lighting is normal, that my eyes are functioning properly, that no tricks are being played on me, and so forth. For if I am not justified in making these assumptions, then my belief that there is a computer in front of me would not be justified. Generalizing, the claim is that our beliefs about the external world are justified only if some set of justified background beliefs is in place.

This argument has also been challenged. The key claim–that my belief that there is a computer in front of me is justified only if I am justified in believing these other things–is not obvious. A young child, for example, might believe there is a computer in front of her, and this belief might be justified, even though she is not yet justified in believing anything about the lighting, her visual processes, and so forth. If this is correct, then the most the argument can show is that if someone has a justified belief that there is a computer in front of them and if they believe that the lighting is normal, that their eyes are functioning well, and so forth, then these latter beliefs had better be justified. This, however, is consistent with foundationalism. Moreover, some epistemologists argue that the psychological realization condition might not be met. For it is implausible to think that I infer that there is a computer in front of me from one or more of my beliefs about the lighting, my eyes, and absence of tricksters. Nor do I infer any of these latter beliefs from my belief that there is a computer in front of me. Maybe this non-content requirement will do instead: my computer belief is counterfactually dependent on my beliefs about the lighting, my eyes, and so forth, so that if I did not have any of the latter beliefs, then I would not have the computer belief either. This is far from obvious, though. Perhaps, in the imagined counterfactual situation, my state is like the child’s. So even a relation of counterfactual dependence might not be needed.

d. For Necessity: The Need for Meta-Beliefs

There is another argument that begins from a prosaic justified belief about the external world. Consider, again, my empirically justified belief that there is a computer in front of me. For this belief to be justified, I must possess some reason for holding it. But to possess a reason is to believe that reason. Since the reason presumably needs to be a good one, I must believe it in such a way that my belief in that reason is a justified belief. This yields a second justified belief. This second justified belief can then be subjected to the same argument, an argument that will yield some third justified belief. And so on.

Foundationalists have charged that this argument is psychologically unrealistic. Surely, having a justified belief that there is a computer in front of me does not require having an infinite number of justified beliefs. Coherentists have a good reason to avoid being committed to this kind of result: it is much more psychologically realistic to posit coherent systems of beliefs that are finite. If this is right, the argument is best thought of as a reductio ad absurdum of one, or more, of the claims that lead to the result – either the claim that justified belief requires possessing a reason, the claim that possessing a reason requires believing that reason, or the claim that possessing a reason requires believing it with justification.

Moreover, this argument does not clearly support coherentism. Instead, it seems to support infinitism. Plus, the demand that it makes is a demand for linear justification: my computer belief relies for its justification on my having a second justified belief; in turn, this second justified belief relies for its justification on my having some third justified belief. These dependency relations are asymmetric one-way relations, the hallmark of linear justification, not coherence justification.

5. Arguments Against Coherentism

This section takes up five arguments against coherentism. These are in addition to the circularity and self-support charges that that were discussed earlier.

a. Against Sufficiency: The Input and Isolation Arguments

One argument against sufficiency coherentism says that it fails to recognize the indispensable role that experience plays in justifying our beliefs about the external world. That sufficiency coherentism gives no essential role to experience follows from the fact that the states that suffice to justify our beliefs are, on this view, limited to other beliefs. That this is grounds for rejecting sufficiency coherentism is spelled out in several different ways. One way appeals to a lack of connection to the truth: since the view does not give any essential role to the central source of input from the external world, namely experience, there is no reason to expect a coherent system of beliefs to accurately reflect the external world. This line of attack is often referred to as the isolation objection. Alternatively, an opponent of sufficiency coherentism might not appeal to truth-conductivity. Instead, she might simply claim that it is implausible to deny that part of what justifies my present belief that there is a computer in front of me is the nature of my present visual and tactile experiences. So even if my experience is not reflective of the truth, perhaps because I am a deceived brain-in-a-vat, my perceptual beliefs will be justified only if they suitably fit with what my perceptual states are reporting.

Of course, proponents of necessity coherentism are free to impose other necessary conditions on justified belief, conditions that can include things about experience. But what about proponents of sufficiency coherentism? How can they respond? Let’s look at three ways. The first is from Laurence BonJour (1985, chapters 6 and 7). BonJour identifies a class of beliefs that he calls cognitively spontaneous beliefs. Roughly, these are non-inferential beliefs that arise in us in a non-voluntary way. A subset of these beliefs can be justified from within one’s system of beliefs by appeal to two other beliefs: the belief that these first-order beliefs occur spontaneously, plus the belief that first-order spontaneous beliefs of a specific kind (a kind individuated by its characteristic subject matter, or by its “apparent mode of sensory production”) tend to be true. According to BonJour, invoking cognitively spontaneous beliefs in this way explains how experience can make a difference to the justificatory status of our beliefs – experiences do this via their being reflected in a subset of our beliefs. BonJour contends that in addition a coherentist must give an account of how experiences must make a difference to the justification of some of our beliefs. Here, he introduces the Observation Requirement: roughly, any system of beliefs that contains empirically justified beliefs must include the belief that a significant likelihood of truth attaches to a reasonable variety of cognitively spontaneous beliefs.

Alternatively, Keith Lehrer (see chapter 6 of his 1990 book) calls on the fact that a human’s typical body of beliefs is going to include beliefs about the conditions under which she reliably forms beliefs. Lehrer points out that this belief is either true or false. If it is true, then in tandem with beliefs about the conditions under which one formed some beliefs, plus the beliefs themselves, the truth of the beliefs, and their being justified, follows. On the other hand, if a belief about the conditions under which one reliably forms beliefs is false, then the justification for the relevant belief is defeated (this entails that one fails to know, though the belief still enjoys what Lehrer calls “personal justification”).

Third, a coherentist might challenge the assumption that experiences and beliefs are distinct. On some views of perceptual states (for example, the view that Armstrong defends in chapter 10 of his 1968 book), perceptual states, or at least a significant class of perceptual states, involve, and entail, believing. On these views, when one of the relevant perceptual states supplies input from the external world, one’s corpus of beliefs is provided with input from the external world. The viability of this response turns on the case for thinking that perceiving is believing.

b. Against Sufficiency: The Alternative Coherent Systems Argument

A second argument against sufficiency coherentism connects in some ways with the last argument. According to this second argument, for each system of coherent beliefs, there are multiple alternative systems – alternative because they include beliefs with different, logically incompatible, contents – that are just as coherent. However, if there are plenty of highly, equally coherent, but incompatible, systems, and if few of these systems do an adequate job of faithfully representing reality, then coherentism is not a good indicator of truth. Since this line of reasoning is readily knowable, beliefs that coherently fit together are not, at least by virtue of their coherence alone, justified.

The exact number of alternative systems that are equally coherent depends on the exact details of what constitutes coherence. But like most of the standard arguments for, and against, coherentism, the soundness of this argument is not thought to turn on these details. Nor is it clear that coherentists can reply by denying the view of epistemic justification invoked in the argument. Even if one were to deny the externalist thesis which says that the mark of justified beliefs is that they are likely to be true, in some objective non-epistemic sense of “likely,” epistemic internalism might not provide refuge. For BonJour, Lehrer, and other internalists, beliefs that are not likely, in the same externalist sense, to be true can be justified: for example, my belief that there is a computer in front of me would be justified even if I were a lifelong deceived brain-in-a-vat. But it is not clear that it is reasonable, by internalist lights, to hold a coherent system of beliefs just because they are coherent, while it is reasonable to believe that there are plenty of alternative equally coherent, but incompatible, belief systems. So, this objection might go through whether one weds coherentism to epistemic externalism or internalism.

A sufficiency coherentist might try to respond to this argument in the same way that she responds to the input problem. She might claim, for example, that a sufficient bulk of a person’s beliefs are cognitively spontaneous beliefs. Since these beliefs are involuntarily acquired, they will constrain the number, and nature, of alternative equally coherent systems that one could have. Alternatively, a large bulk of our beliefs will be firmly in place if perceiving is believing.

c. Against Necessity: Feasibility Problems

Let’s turn to some arguments against necessity coherentism. It is highly plausible that humans have plenty of justified beliefs. So, if justification requires coherence, it must be psychologically realistic to think that each of us has coherent systems of beliefs. How psychologically realistic is this?

Again, the answer depends, in part, on the make up of the coherence relation. As we saw, coherence at a minimum requires logical consistency. Christopher Cherniak (see Cherniak 1984) considers using a truth-table to determine whether a system of 138 beliefs is logically consistent. If one were so quick that one could check each line of the truth table for this long conjunction in the time it takes a light ray to traverse the diameter of a proton, it would still take more than twenty billion years to work through the entire table. Since 138 beliefs is hardly an inordinate number of beliefs for a system to have, it appears that coherence cannot be checked for in any humanly feasible way.

While this sort of consideration might pose a problem for a position that couples coherentism with internalism (as BonJour and Lehrer do), coherentism itself does not require a person to verify that it is logically consistent. It does not even require that a person be able to verify this. It just requires that the system in fact be logically consistent. Still, there might be problems in the neighborhood. One is that Cherniak’s point might well imply that we do not form, or sustain, our beliefs in virtue of their coherence, since any cognitive mechanism that could do this would need to be much more powerful than any mechanisms we have. Second, it is highly plausible to think that we are often in a position to show that our beliefs are justified; but Cherniak’s point suggests that if coherentism were right, this would often be beyond our abilities.

d. Against Necessity: The Preface Paradox

Another argument questions whether logical inconsistency, an obvious mark of incoherence, really entails a lack of justification. Imagine an historian who has just completed her lifelong book project. She has double and triple checked each claim that she makes in the book, and each has checked out. For each of the claims she makes, c1, ….. cn, she has a justified belief that it is true: she has the justified belief that c1 is true, the justified belief that c2 is true, … , and the justified belief that cn is true. At the same time, she is fully aware of the fact that historians make mistakes. In all likelihood, her book contains at least one mistake. For this reason, she is justified in believing that at least one of the claims that she makes in her book is false. But this yields a set of beliefs that is not logically consistent, since it includes the belief that c1 is true, the belief that c2 is true, … , the belief that cn is true, and the belief that at least one of c1 through cn is false. Some epistemologists, for example, Foley 1992, have argued that the historian is justified in believing this set of logically inconsistent claims. And, all of these beliefs remain justified even if she knows they are logically inconsistent.

In response, the coherentist might appropriate any of a number of views on this Preface Paradox. For example, John Pollock (1986) has suggested a simple reason for thinking that the historian’s beliefs cannot be both logically inconsistent and justified. Since a set of inconsistent propositions logically implies anything whatsoever, adding a widely accepted principle concerning justification will yield the result that one can be justified in believing anything whatsoever. The principle is the closure principle: roughly, it says that if one is justified in believing some set of propositions and one is justified in believing that those propositions logically imply some other proposition, then upon deducing this other proposition from the set that one starts from, one is justified in believing that proposition.

A second set of cases involve beliefs that are logically inconsistent, although this is unknown to the person who holds them. For example, while Frege had good reason to believe that the axioms of arithmetic that he came up with were consistent, Russell showed that in fact they were not consistent. It is quite plausible that Frege’s beliefs in each of the axioms were, though logically inconsistent, nonetheless justified (see Kornblith 1989). BonJour (1989) responded to this case, as well as the Preface Paradox, by agreeing that both Frege’s, and the historian’s beliefs, are justified. He claimed that logical consistency is overrated; it is, in fact, not an essential component of coherence.

e. Against Necessity: Counterexamples

There appear to be straightforward counterexamples to coherentism. Introspective beliefs constitute an important class of such cases. On a broad interpretation of “empirical” that encompasses sources of belief in addition to the sensory modalities (one that contrasts with the a priori), introspective beliefs count as empirical. Consider, then, my introspective belief that I am in pain, or my introspective belief that something looks red to me. These beliefs are not inferred from any other beliefs – I did not arrive at either of them by inference from premises. They are not based on any other beliefs.

In response, Lehrer (1990, p. 89) has suggested that a coherentist might identify one, or more, background beliefs, and claim that, though the introspective belief is not inferred from these background belief, the introspective belief is justified because it coheres with the background beliefs. For example, to handle the introspective belief that something looks red to me, Lehrer points to the background belief that if I believe something looks red to me then, unless something untoward is going on, the best explanation is that there is something that does look red to me.

It is not clear that this response works. Let R be the proposition that something looks red to me. Lehrer’s suggestion requires that coherence holds between (i) R and (ii) if I believe R, then R. It is not clear, though, that coherence does hold between these. Though they are logically consistent, neither entails the other; moreover, they need not be inductively related to one another; nor is it clear that either explains the other.

6. Looking Ahead

Intense discussion of coherentism has been intermittent. Two recent defenses of the position, Laurence BonJour’s 1985 The Structure of Empirical Knowledge and Keith Lehrer’s 1990 version of Knowledge, significantly advanced the issues and triggered substantial literatures, which mostly attacked coherentism. But undoubtedly, work on coherentism has suffered from the fact that so few philosophers are coherentists. Even BonJour, who did so much to reinvigorate the discussion, has abandoned coherentism. See his 1999 paper for his renunciation. With the exception of work being done by Bayesians, few epistemologists are presently working on coherentism.

Epistemology would be better off if this were not so. For even if coherentism falls to some objection, it would be nice if we had a better idea of exactly what range of positions fall. Moreover, when it comes to the task of clarifying the nature of coherence, an appeal can be made to many foundationalists. While there might not be much motivation to develop a position that one rejects, there is this: many foundationalists want to incorporate considerations about coherence. As we saw, they usually do this in one of two ways, either by allowing coherence to boost the level of justification enjoyed by beliefs that are independently justified in some non-coherentist fashion, or by stamping incoherent beliefs as unjustified. Defending these conditions on justification requires clarifying the nature of coherence. So, it is not just coherentists that have a stake in clarifying coherence.

7. References and Further Reading

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Armstrong, David. (1968) A Materialist Theory of the Mind. New York: Routledge.
Audi, Robert. (1993) The Structure of Justification. New York: Cambridge University Press.
Aune, Bruce. (1967) Knowledge, Mind, and Nature. New York: Random House.
Blanshard, Brand. (1939) The Nature of Thought. New York: G. Allen and Unwin Ltd.
BonJour, Laurence. (1985) The Structure of Empirical Knowledge. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
BonJour, Laurence. (1989) “Replies and Clarificiations.” In John Bender, ed., The Current State of the Coherence Theory. Dordrecht: Kluwer.
BonJour, Laurence. (1999) “The Dialectic of Foundationalism and Coherentism.” In John Greco and Ernest Sosa, eds., The Blackwell Guide to Epistemology. Malden, MA: Blackwell.
Cherniak, Christopher. (1984) “Computational Complexity and the Universal Acceptance of Logic.” Journal of Philosophy 81: 739-758.
Chisholm, Roderick. (1982) The Foundations of Knowing. Minneapolis, MN: University of Minnesota Press.
Chisholm, Roderick (1989) Theory of Knowledge 3rd edition. Englewood Cliffs, CA: Prentice Hall.
Cross, Charles. (1999) “Coherence and Truth Conducive Justification.” Analysis 59: 186-193.
Daniels, Norman. (1996) Justice and Justification: Reflective Equilibrium in Theory and Practice. Cambridge, MA: Cambridge University Press.
Davidson, Donald. (1986) “A Coherence Theory of Truth and Knowledge.” In Ernest LePore, ed., Truth and Interpretation: Perspectives on the Philosophy of Donald Davidson. New York: Blackwell.
Earman, John. (1992) Bayes or Bust? Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Elgin, Catherine. (2005) “Non-foundationalist Epistemology: Holism, Coherence, and Tenability.” In Matthias Steup and Ernest Sosa, eds., Contemporary Debates in Epistemology. Malden, MA: Blackwell.
Foley, Richard. (1978) “Inferential Justification and the Infinite Regress.” American Philosophical Quarterly 15: 311-316.
Foley, Richard. (1987) The Theory of Epistemic Rationality. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
Foley, Richard. (1992) “Being Knowingly Incoherent.” Nous 26: 181-203.
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Harman, Gilbert. (1986) Change in View. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
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Klein, Peter. (1999) “Human Knowledge and the Infinite Regress of Reasons.” Philosophical Perspectives 13: 297-325.
Klein, Peter and Ted Warfield. (1994) “What Price Coherence?” Analysis 54: 129-132.
Klein, Peter and Ted Warfield. (1996) “No Help for the Coherentist.” Analysis 56: 118-121.
Kornblith, Hilary. (1989). “The Unattainability of Coherence.” In John Bender, ed., The Current State of the Coherence Theory. Dordrecht: Kluwer.
Kvanvig, Jonathan. (1995) “Coherentists’ Distractions.” Philosophical Topics 23: 257-75.
Kvanvig, Jonathan. (2003) “Coherentist Theories of Epistemic Justification, Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
Kvanvig, Jonathan. (2003) The Value of Knowledge and the Pursuit of Understanding. New York: Cambridge University Press.
Kvanvig, Jonathan and Wayne Riggs. (1992) “Can a Coherence Theory Appeal to Appearance States?” Philosophical Studies 67: 197-217.
Lehrer, Keith. (1974) Knowledge. New York: Oxford University Press.
Lehrer, Keith. (1997) “Justification, Coherence, and Knowledge.” Erkenntnis 50: 243-257.
Lehrer, Keith. (1990) Theory of Knowledge. Boulder, CO: Westview Press.
Lewis, C.I. (1946) An Analysis of Knowledge and Valuation. LaSalle, IL: Open Court.
Lycan, William. (1988) Judgment and Justification. New York: Cambridge University Press.
Lycan, William. (1996) “Plantinga and Coherentisms.” In Jonathan Kvanvig, ed., Warrant in Contemporary Epistemology. Totowa, N.J.: Rowman and Littlefield.
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Olsson, Erik. (2001) “Why Coherence is not Truth-Conducive.” Analysis 61: 236-241.
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Shogenji, Tomoji. (1999) “Is Coherence Truth-Conducive?” Analysis 59: 338-345.
Shogenji, Tomoji. (2001) “Reply to Akiba on the Probabilistic Measure of Coherence.” Analysis 61: 147-150.
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van Fraassen, Bas. (1989) Laws and Symmetry. New York: Oxford University Press.

Author Information

Peter Murphy
Email: pjmurphy469@yahoo.com
University of Indianapolis
U. S. A.

Sartre’s Political Philosophy

French philosopher Jean-Paul Sartre (1905-1980), the best known European public intellectual of the twentieth century, developed a highly original political philosophy, influenced in part by the work of Hegel and Marx. Although he wrote little on ethics or politics prior to World War II, political themes dominated his writings from 1945 onwards. Sartre co-founded the journal Les Temps Modernes, which would publish many seminal essays on political theory and world affairs. The most famous example is Sartre’s Anti-Semite and Jew, a blistering criticism of French complicity in the Holocaust which also put forth the general thesis that oppression is a distortion of interpersonal recognition. In the 1950’s Sartre moved towards Marxism and eventually released Critique of Dialectical Reason, Vol. 1 (1960), a massive, systematic account of history and group struggle. In addition to presenting a new critical theory of society based on a synthesis of psychology and sociology, Critique qualified Sartre’s earlier, more radical view of existential freedom. His last systematic work, The Family Idiot (1971), would express his final and most nuanced views on the relation between individuals and social wholes. Sartre’s pioneering combination of Existentialism and Marxism yielded a political philosophy uniquely sensitive to the tension between individual freedom and the forces of history. As a Marxist he believed that societies were best understood as arenas of struggle between powerful and powerless groups. But as an Existentialist he held individuals personally responsible for vast and apparently authorless social ills. The chief existential virtue—authenticity—would require a person to lucidly examine his or her social situation and accept personal culpability for the choices made in this situation. Unlike competing versions of Marxism, Sartre’s Existentialist-Marxism was based on a striking theory of individual agency and moral responsibility.

In addition to class analysis, Sartre offered critiques of anti-Semitism, racism, violence and colonialism. His theoretical account of oppression re-worked Hegel’s master/slave dialectic, arguing that oppression is a concrete, historical instance of mastery. To oppress another is to attempt to validate one’s sense of self by denying the freedom of another. The self-contradictory nature of oppression led him to the optimistic conclusion that oppression is not an inevitable, ontological condition, but a historical reality that should be contested, through both self-assertion and collective action. As a social-political thinker, Sartre defended a large number of innovative methodological and substantive theses. He steered a middle path between reductive individualism and ontological holism. He answered the perennial question “What defines a social group?” with an ingenious re-working of Hegelian recognition. His account of the fusion and disillusion of social groups remains unique to this day. Both broad and original, Sartre’s social-political theory is one of the great contributions to twentieth century philosophy.

Texts
Hegelian-Marxism
Freedom
Oppression
Engagement
Ideal Society
Conclusion
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources
2. Secondary Sources

1. Texts

Sartre’s prolific writings span multiple genres and have variously been divided into two or three major phases (early and late; or early, middle and late). Sartre’s political writings began in earnest after World War II. In prewar works like Nausea (La Nausée, 1938) and Being and Nothingness (L’Etre et le Néant, 1943) Sartre wrote almost exclusively about individual psychology, imagination and consciousness. Sartre’s primary goal in these works was to discredit determinism and defend the creativity, contingency and freedom of human action. While Sartre’s prewar works are apolitical and inward, his postwar works are politically engaged and historical. The political shift in Sartre’s thinking is reflected by his adoption of the term “praxis” rather than “consciousness” as the active term in his analysis. Turning away from pure psychology, Sartre’s central concerns in the postwar period become group struggle, oppression and the nature of history.

The main theoretical texts of Sartre’s post-war period are Critique of Dialectical Reason (Critique de la raison dialectique Vol.1, 1960, and Vol. 2, 1985) and The Family Idiot (L’Idiot de la famille, 1971). In addition to these theoretical tomes (both over 1,000 pages), Sartre wrote a large number of political essays, most of which were first published in Modern Times (Les Temps modernes), the journal founded by Sartre and others in 1945. The significant essays have been collected in a ten volume set by Gallimard entitled Situations. Of the four novels and nine major plays Sartre published, many have political content.

While writing frequently and passionately about politics and ethics, Sartre never published a systematic philosophical treatise outlining his political or ethical views. There is no Sartrean equivalent to Hegel’s Philosophy of Right, Rousseau’s On the Social Contract, or Mill’s On Liberty. His political philosophy emerges from his situational pieces, which were reactions to contemporary political issues, such as the Algerian and Vietnam Wars, French Anti-Semitism and Soviet communism. Critique of Dialectical Reason is the major work of Sartre’s political phase, and is the closest approximation to a work of traditional political philosophy in his corpus. The main themes of Critique include the nature of social groups, history, and dialectical reason. Critique only briefly addresses the canonical themes of political philosophy, such as the theory of the state, political obligation, citizenship, justice and rights.

2. Hegelian-Marxism

Sartre’s contributions to political philosophy are best understood from within the historical context of Hegelianism and Marxism. His political views were influenced heavily by Hegel. In Being and Nothingness he shows some familiarity with the work of Hegel, but this knowledge was indirect and piecemeal. Sartre did not begin a serious study of Hegel until the late 1940s. Between 1947 and 1948 he composed a series of notebooks outlining his plans for a major work in ethical theory. The surviving notebooks, published posthumously as Notebooks for an Ethics (Cahiers pour une morale, 1982), reveal that he developed his own political views through a dialogue with Hegel and Marx. Above all, Sartre was concerned to rethink the master/slave dialectic of Hegel’s Phenomenology of Spirit. In Being and Nothingness he agreed with Hegel that humans struggle against one another to win recognition, but rejected the possibility of transcending struggle through relations of reciprocal, mutual recognition. Sartre thought that all human relations were variations of the master/slave relation (see Being and Nothingness,pp. 471-534). However, in the Notebooks, and in the works published beginning in the late 1940s, he dramatically altered his thinking on master/slave relations. First, he accepted the possibility that struggle could be transcended through mutual, reciprocal recognition. His best example was the collaboration between artists and their audience. Second, he located the struggle for recognition in society and history, not in ontology. Third, Sartre’s historical view of the struggle for recognition allowed him to analyze oppression as a type of domination. Finally, he came to agree that social solidarity was not, as claimed in Being and Nothingness, a mere psychological projection, but an ontological reality, based on ties of recognition. In short, Sartre’s main contributions in social and political philosophy were in large part due to his original adaptation and expansion on the Hegelian ideal of intersubjective recognition.

Some scholars contend that Sartre’s normative ethical assumptions (including, by extension, his political views) were derived from Kant. It is true that his best known work, “Existentialism is a Humanism” (“L’Existentialisme est un humanisme,” 1945), presented a universalization argument similar to Kant’s categorical imperative. However, the majority of his works speak critically of Kant. The influence of Hegel vastly outweighs that of Kant. In the autobiographical film Sartre by Himself (Sartre par lui-même, 1976), Sartre admits a deep dissatisfaction with the popularity of Existentialism is a Humanism, a short lecture that was subsequently turned into a widely-distributed essay. In Notebooks, where Sartre reflects on ethics for an extended period, he rejects Kantian ethics, calling it a form of “slave morality” and an “ethics of demands” (pp. 237-274). While he speaks favorably of a “kingdom of ends,” this phrase refers to a socialist society, not a community governed by Kant’s categorical imperative.

Marx’s influence on Sartre is undeniable. While he identified with the French Left prior to the war, experiences during the war politicized him and motivated the turn to Marxism. Sartre’s Marxism was always accompanied by his existentialism. Overwhelmingly devoted to ontological and phenomenological explanations, he would powerfully describe social reality using Marxist structural analysis. The result was a highly original political theory that, while recognizably Marxist, did not resemble the work of structuralist contemporaries such as Louis Althusser. Sartre described himself as rescuing Marxism from lazy dogmatism (Search for a Method, pp. 21 and 27). Like his contemporaries in Germany at the Frankfurt School for Social Research, he sought to develop a general critical theory of society. While accepting the reality of economic class, he strongly criticized those who reduced all social conflicts and all personal motivations to class. In his political period, Sartre deepened his psychological explanations of human behavior by contextualizing individual action within wide social structures (class, family, nation, and so on). He held that economic class was only one of many important structural factors that explained human action. Vehemently criticizing all forms of social scientific reductionism, he claimed that the human situation includes birth, death, family, nationality, gender, race and body, to name only the most relevant (Anti-Semite and Jew, pp. 59-60). Like later analytic Marxists, he would claim that “objective interests” are insufficient to explain the intentions of individual agents. Class analysis must be combined with personal history.

The massive Critique of Dialectical Reason is Sartre’s defense of the unity of Existentialism and Marxism. He showed that functionalist explanations of social phenomena could be grounded in the intentional states of individual agents. Search for a Method (Question de méthode, 1967), the preface to the French Critique, formulates the “progressive-regressive” method, which melds psychological and sociological explanations of human action. The two major components of the method are a regressive analysis of static social structures such as class, family and era, and a second progressive analysis where complex permutations of structures are explained from the lived perspective of individuals and groups. In his existential biographies, such as those on G. Flaubert, S. Mallarmé, and J. Genet, Sartre applies the progressive-regressive method, arguing that individuals “incarnate” (internalize and express) the major social events, movements and values of their era. His view should not be confused with deterministic Marxism, which holds that individuals are mere pawns in a historical game that would be the same with or without them. Individuals have the power to change history, especially through group struggle.

In addition to its methodological contributions, Critique offers a broad account of history, social groups and mass phenomenon. Sartre’s dialectical theory of society, written in the spirit of Hegel and Marx, holds that group struggle is the animating principle of human history. Pace Hegel, Sartre rejects group minds, arguing that there is a basic ontological distinction between the action of persons (individual praxis) and the action of groups (group praxis) (Critique, pp. 345-8). While groups exhibit collective intentionality, no group is a literal organism. Individuals are ontologically prior to the groups they create. Sartre would label his unique approach to social reality “dialectical nominalism” (Critique, p. 37).

In Critique, social groups are divided into four main types: fusing groups, pledge groups, organizations, and institutions (see “Book II: From Groups to History”). Distinct from genuine groups, social “collectives” are semi-unified gatherings of individuals where collective action and mutual recognition are absent (Critique, p. 254). Under Sartre’s pen these distinctions come to life. His analysis of the Bastille is a case in point. Rioting citizens were transformed from a disorganized collective into a group by internalizing the perspective of government officials who thought the rioters were a coherent movement with a single aim (Critique, pp. 351-5). Throughout Critique Sartre develops his foundational claim that social groups are unified when they internalize threatening features of their environment. A “fraternity-terror” dynamic (Critique, p. 430) exists not only in spontaneous groups, but also in oath-based groups and highly bureaucratic institutions.

The social theory of Critique is a far cry from Being and Nothingness, which had asserted that social groups were mere psychological projections (Being and Nothingness, p.536). Critique introduces a new technical concept, that of “mediating third parties,” to explain the nature of groups above and beyond I-thou relations (pp. 100-9). Mediating third parties are members of groups who temporarily act as external threats (for example, when giving orders) but who subsequently re-enter the group (Critique, p.373). The concept of the mediating third party allows Sartre to extend his theory of interpersonal recognition beyond the fictionalized, abstract encounter between self and other, and better explain the fundamentals of group solidarity.

The direct political implications of Critique’s group theory are ambiguous. One popular, plausible interpretation holds that spontaneous groups (for example, fusing and pledge groups) promote human freedom, while bureaucratic groups (such as organizations and institutions) engender alienation. Characteristically, Sartre uses moral terminology to describe groups, but subsequently distances himself from moral conclusions. Institutions, for example, are “degraded forms of community” where “freedom . . . becomes alienated and hidden from its own eyes.” (Critique, pp. 615 and 591). Nonetheless, any politics consistent with Critique would have to favor spontaneous, decentralized social groups.

The concept of alienation also plays an important role in Sartre’s thinking. In Notebooks he defines alienation as being an “other” to oneself (p. 382). In Critique he uses the terms “serialized” and “atomized” to describe persons who are alienated from one another. Unlike Being and Nothingness, where alienation is depicted as an unavoidable ontological condition, in the later political works alienation is rooted in material scarcity. If material scarcity can be eliminated, then we might enjoy “a margin of real freedom, beyond the production of life” (Search for a Method, p. 34).

For most of his life, Sartre remained at a distance from party politics and articulated his political principles without reference to any existing parties. In 1948, however, he co-founded a short-lived non-Communist leftist party, the Rassemblement Démocratique Révolutionnaire. From 1952 to 1956 Sartre supported but did not join the French Communist Party. Later he became disillusioned by the soviet invasion of Hungary and distanced his vision of socialism from Soviet-style communism. In the last years of his life, Sartre associated himself with Maoist groups and took as a personal secretary the young Jewish-Egyptian Maoist Benny Lévy.

On the whole, Sartre’s contributions to Hegelian-Marxism are substantial. He forcefully argued against deterministic, structuralist versions of Marxism, inserting human subjectivity back into the equation. With a keen eye towards interpersonal relations, he showed that social struggle, whether among classes, races or interest groups, must be understood simultaneously at the psychological and the systemic level. Sartre, more than any Marxist of his generation, exposed the limits of classical Marxism and paved the way for a general critical theory of society.

3. Freedom

The concept of freedom, central to Sartre’s system as a whole, is a dominant theme in his political works. Sartre’s view of freedom changed substantially throughout his lifetime. Scholars disagree whether there is a fundamental continuity or a radical break between Sartre’s early view of freedom and his late view of freedom. There is a strong consensus, though, that after World War II Sartre shifted to a material view of freedom, in contrast to the ontological view of his early period. According to the arguments of Being and Nothingness human freedom consists in the ability of consciousness to transcend its material situation (p. 563). Later, especially in Critique of Dialectical Reason, Sartre shifts to the view that humans are only free if their basic needs as practical organisms are met (p. 327). Let us look at these two different notions of freedom in more depth.

Early Sartre views freedom as synonymous with human consciousness. Consciousness (“being-for-itself”) is marked by its non-coincidence with itself. In simple terms, consciousness escapes itself both because it is intentional (consciousness always targets an object other than itself) and temporal (consciousness is necessarily future oriented) (Being and Nothingness, pp. 573-4 and 568). Sartre’s view that human freedom consists in consciousness’ ability to escape the present is “ontological” in the sense that no normal human being can fail to be free. The subtitle of Being and Nothingness, “An Essay in Phenomenological Ontology,” reveals Sartre’s aim of describing the fundamental structures of human existence and answering the question “What does it mean to be human?” His answer is that humans, unlike inert matter, are conscious and therefore free.

The notion of ontological freedom is controversial and has often been rejected because it implies that humans are free in all situations. In his early work Sartre embraced this implication unflinchingly. Famously, Sartre claimed the French public was as free as ever during the Nazi occupation. In Being and Nothingness, he passionately argued that even prisoners are free because they have the power of consciousness (p. 622). A prisoner, though coerced, can choose how to react to his imprisonment. The prisoner is free because he controls his reaction to imprisonment: he may resist or acquiesce. Since there are no objective barriers to the will, the prison bars restrain me only if I form the will to escape. In a similar example, Sartre notes that a mountain is only a barrier if the individual wants to get on the other side but cannot (Being and Nothingness, p. 628).

Sartre’s ontological notion of freedom has been widely criticized, from both political and ontological standpoints. An important contemporary critic of Sartre’s work was his colleague Maurice Merleau-Ponty, whose essay “Sartre and Ultrabolshevism” directly attacked Sartre’s Cartesianism and his ontological conception of freedom (Merleau-Ponty, Adventures of the Dialectic, 1955).

While Sartre never renounced the ontological view of freedom, in later works he became critical of what he then called the “stoical” and “Cartesian” view that freedom consists in the ability to change one’s attitude no matter what the situation (Notebooks, pp. 331 and 387; Critique, pp. 332 and 578 fn). It is an open question whether and how to reconcile the early, ontological conception of freedom with the late, material conception of freedom. However, it is undeniable that in his political phase Sartre adopted a new, material view of freedom. Several points stand out in particular. In later works he never again used the notion of consciousness to characterize human existence, preferring instead the Marxist notion of praxis. Further, he came to emphasize the “situation” (i.e. structural influences) in explaining individual choice and psychology (Anti-Semite and Jew, pp. 59-60). Finally, he criticized all “inward” notions of freedom, claiming that a change of attitude is insufficient for real freedom.

Sartre’s shift to a material conception of freedom was motivated directly by the holocaust and World War II. Anti-Semite and Jew (Réflexions sur la question juive, 1946), published just after the war, was the first of many works analyzing moral responsibility for oppression. The fact that Sartre’s view in Being and Nothingness seemed to leave little room for diagnosing oppression did not stop him from articulating a forceful normative critique of Anti-Semitism. His analysis of oppression would, in fact, use the same dialectical tools as those in the section on “concrete relations with others” in Being and Nothingness. Anti-Semite and Jew argues that oppression is a master/slave relationship, where the master denies the freedom of the slave and yet becomes dependent on the slave (pp. 27, 39 and 135). Sartre modified his notion of “the look” by arguing that only some, not all, interpersonal relations result in alienation and loss of freedom.

Sartre’s new appreciation of oppression as a concrete loss of human freedom forced him to alter his view that humans are free in any situation. He did not explicitly discuss such alterations, though clearly abandoning the view that humans are free in all situations. “[I]t is important not to conclude that one can be free in chains,” and “It would be quite wrong to interpret me as saying that man is free in all situations as the Stoics claimed” (Critique, pp. 578 and 332). Sartre’s basic assumption in his political writings is that oppression is a loss of freedom (Critique, p. 332). Since humans can never lose their ontological freedom, the loss of freedom in question must be of a different sort: oppression must compromise material freedom.

Take the case of the prisoner. The prisoner is ontologically free because she controls whether to attempt escape. On this view, freedom is synonymous with choice. But there is no qualitative distinction between types of choices. If freedom is the existence of choice, then even a bad choice is freedom promoting. As he will put it later, an attacker who gives me the choice of “what sauce to be eaten in” could hardly be said to meaningfully promote my freedom (Notebooks, p. 331). The early view is subject to the charge that if there are no qualitative distinctions between types of choices, then the phenomena of oppression and coercion cannot be recognized.

In Anti-Semite and Jew and Notebooks Sartre implicitly addresses the above criticism, arguing that oppression consists not in the absence of choice, but in being forced to choose between bad, inhumane options (Notebooks, pp. 334-5). Jews in anti-Semitic societies, for example, are forced to choose between self-effacement or caricatured self-identities (Anti-Semite and Jew, pp. 135 and 148). In Critique Sartre uses the example of a labor contract to illustrate the claim that choice is not synonymous with freedom (Critique, pp. 721-2). An impoverished person who accepts a degrading, low wage job for the sake of meeting her basic needs has a choice—she may starve or accept a degrading job—but her choice is inhumane. He does not claim that diffuse social structures like poverty have the literal agency of individual human beings, but that class structure is a “destiny” and we can speak cogently of social forces which exert causality and turn us into “slaves” (Critique, p. 332).

In the political period as a whole Sartre developed his material view of freedom by contrasting the free person with the slave. Though his notion of slavery is derived from Hegel, Sartre, unlike Hegel, diagnosed literal cases like American chattel slavery. Sartre follows Hegel in portraying slavery as a form of “non-mutual recognition” where one person dominates the other psychologically and physically. A slave, he argues, is un-free because he is dominated by a master (Notebooks pp. 325-411). Material freedom requires, therefore, non-domination, or freedom from coercion. He adds that in master/slave relations, the self-conception of the victim and perpetrator are intertwined and distorted; both parties are in “bad faith”; both fail to fully understand their own freedom. Though both perpetrator and victim are in bad faith, only the slave is coerced physically (Notebooks, p. 331).

Sartre’s view of material freedom is independent of any notion of human nature. He consistently rejects the existence of a pre-social human essence or a set of natural human desires (“Existentialism is a Humanism”; Anti-Semite and Jew, p. 49; Search for a Method, pp. 167-181). The material view of freedom assumes a thin set of universal human goods, including positive human goods (food, water, shelter and education) and negative goods (freedom from all of the following: slavery, poverty, discrimination, domination and persecution). While Critique elaborates an economic understanding of human goods (the essential needs are those of the physical organism), elsewhere Sartre defends a wider spectrum of human needs including cultural goods and access to shared values (Notebooks pp. 329-331). In sum, we can say that a person is materially free in Sartre’s sense if (a) she enjoys basic material security; (b) she is un-coerced; and (c) she has access to cultural and social goods necessary for pursuing her chosen projects.

The foregoing definition casts Sartre as an ally of political liberalism, and suggests that material freedom is a version of liberal autonomy. Liberals who defend the primacy of autonomy typically claim that positive notions of freedom assume substantive, controversial conceptions of the good life. Indeed, Sartre’s rejection of human nature and his thin conception of universal human goods are consistent with liberalism. However, Sartre criticizes classical liberalism, especially in Critique, arguing against asocial, atomistic notions of selfhood (p. 311). Further, like civic republican philosophers (such as Aristotle and Rousseau), Sartre contends that controlling the social forces to which one is subject is a valuable type of human freedom. Republican philosophers variously call such freedom “self-government” or “non-domination.” Whether Sartre’s view of freedom is a better fit with contemporary liberalism or civic republicanism is a matter of speculation. Sartre’s discussion of freedom in Critique is highly abstract and does not translate simply into one public policy or another. However, his preference for mass movements and bottom-up social organization suggest that he would favor radical participatory democracy. After the student revolts of May 1968 Sartre told an interviewer: “For me the movement in May was the first large-scale social movement which temporarily brought about something akin to freedom and which then tried to conceive of what freedom in action is” (Life/Situations, p. 52).

4. Oppression

The analysis of oppression is one of Sartre’s most original contributions to political philosophy. Adapting the master/slave dialectic of Hegel’s Phenomenology of Spirit, Sartre developed a general theory of oppression that yielded moral critiques of anti-Semitism, colonialism, class bigotry and anti-black racism.

Consistent with his general methodology, Sartre denied that oppression reduces to either individual attitudes or impersonal social structures. Oppression is simultaneously “praxis” (the result of intentional acts) and “process” (a supra-individual phenomenon, irreducible to intentional states of individuals) (Critique,pp. 716-735). Oppression is defined by Sartre as the “exploitation of man by man . . . characterized by the fact that one class deprives the members of another class of their freedom” (Notebooks, p. 562). On the interpersonal level, oppression is a master/slave relationship; the oppressor tries to gain a robust sense of selfhood by dominating others. Sartre, like Hegel, showed that domination is a self-defeating practical attitude. The dominator tries to force others to recognize him as superior; but ironically, the dominator receives little confirmation of his superiority as he has ruled out in advance the weight of others’ judgments (Anti-Semite and Jew, p. 27; see also Simone de Beauvoir’s Ethics of Ambiguity, 1947, especially pp. 60-63). Sartre’s analysis works particularly well at diagnosing attitudes of racial superiority. An anti-Semite bases his self-image on the fact that he is not-a-Jew, but in so doing, he becomes depended upon the Jewish other from whom he claims total independence. Ultimately, the racist receives no satisfaction from domination because he solicits recognition from someone he denigrates.

The concept of bad faith also plays an important role in Sartre’s analysis of oppression. Bad faith is an original notion developed by Sartre, first in Being and Nothingness, and subsequently in Anti-Semite and Jew, Saint Genet and Situations. Despite his quip that bad faith does not imply moral blame, Sartre’s discussions of bad faith are heavily moralistic. Bad faith is a deep confusion about one’s own basic projects, attitudes, desires and actions. Bad faith is self-deception (See Being and Nothingness, pp. 86-119). And just as freedom is the chief value of existentialism, bad faith—misrecognizing one’s freedom—is the chief existential vice. In particular, racists are in bad faith if they believe humans have racial “essences” or “natures” (Anti-Semite and Jew, pp. 17, 20, 27 and 53). Race, Sartre claims, is socially constructed. The biological view of race, which says there are innate racial character traits, causes a host of distortions and misinterpretations of human action. Most fundamentally, the appeal to essences causes us to abdicate responsibility and blame our freely chosen actions on fictitious inner drives and motives. In Notebooks Sartre expanded his analysis of racist bad faith by arguing that all oppression, not just racist oppression, requires bad faith: “One oppresses only if one oppresses himself” (Notebooks, p.325).

Controversially, Sartre claimed that both perpetrators and victims of oppression exhibit bad faith. In Anti-Semite and Jew Sartre distinguished “authentic” from “non-authentic” Jews, arguing that inauthentic Jews (those who either ignore racism or internalize negative stereotypes) are in bad faith (pp. 44, 93, 96, 109 and 136). Existential authenticity, the ethical virtue that opposes bad faith, does not amount to embracing one’s biology or heritage. Rather, authenticity consists in properly affirming one’s own freedom through clarified reflection and responsible action. In Anti-Semite and Jew Sartre defines authenticity as follows:

If it is agreed that man may be defined as a being having freedom within the limits of a situation, then it is easy to see that the exercise of this freedom may be considered as authentic or inauthentic according to the choices made in the situation. Authenticity, it is almost needless to say, consists in having a true and lucid consciousness of the situation, in assuming the responsibilities and risks that it involves, in accepting it in pride or humiliation, sometimes in horror and hate. (p. 90)

While Sartre emphasized the lonely, individualistic aspect of affirming one’s freedom, (especially in early fiction like The Flies [Les Mouches, 1943]), he also explored the intersubjective conditions of authenticity. At times Sartre endorsed the view, held by fellow existentialist Simone de Beauvoir, that a proper relation to one’s own freedom requires affirming the freedom of others (de Beauvoir, The Ethics of Ambiguity, p. 67; Sartre Notebooks, pp. 475–79). In “Existentialism is a Humanism,” Sartre gestured towards the interconnection of human freedoms, claiming that to will one’s own freedom required willing the freedom of others. But only later, in his unpublished writings on ethics did he fully explain his view: “If I grasp my freedom in a fulfilled intuition as both the source of all my projects and requiring universal freedom, I cannot think of destroying the freedom of others” (Notebooks, p. 328). His belief that each person’s freedom is connected to the freedom of others pervades his discussion of oppression in Notebooks.

Critique of Dialectical Reason offers a macro-social phenomenology of oppression. Oppression “serializes” (i.e. disperses and alienates) members of underprivileged collectives (Critique, pp. 721–3). Sartre’s view, while indebted to Marx’s notion of alienation, reflects his own unique blend of Marxism and Existentialism. “By alienation we mean a certain type of relations that man has with himself, with others and with the world, where he posits the ontological priority of the Other” (Notebooks, p. 382). The architecture of Critique as a whole depends on the distinction between alienating (“serial”) and non-alienating (“group praxis”) social relationships. Social relations range from utterly non-unified social “collectives” to groups that exhibit various levels of awareness and reciprocity. Written during the Algerian war, Critique frequently cites French colonialism in Africa as an example of serial, alienating action. Colonialism creates a climate of hostility where each person is alien to himself and alien to other members of his collective (Critique, pp. 716-721). Serialized collectives tend not to organize themselves into resistance groups and tend to lack awareness of their potential group power. For example, desperately impoverished Algerians compete against each other for low wage jobs and unintentionally harm the entire collective by driving down wages for everyone.

Sartre shows, then, that oppression is both an interpersonal dynamic and a social-institutional phenomenon. Adopting Hegel’s master/slave dialectic, he claims that oppressors attempt to validate their own sense of superiority by dominating others. Like Hegel, Sartre sees domination as ultimately self-defeating. To oppress requires implicitly acknowledging the victim’s humanity in order to subsequently revoke it. On the psychological level, the oppressor lives in bad faith, misunderstanding his own freedom and the freedom of his victim. In later works, especially Critique, the psychological portrait of oppression is mapped onto a macro-social analysis of group struggle. Institutionalized racism is seen as a special case of bureaucratic dehumanization. Victims of racist oppression become alienated, both from themselves and from one another, making organized resistance unlikely. Sartre’s lasting contribution to the politics of oppression consists in persuasively combining interpersonal and institutional explanations of oppression.

5. Engagement

Engagement is a specialized term in the Sartrean vocabulary and refers to the process of accepting responsibility for the political consequences of one’s actions. Sartre, more than any other philosopher of the period, defended the notion of socially responsible writing (littérature engagée). Like Italian Marxist Antonio Gramsci, Sartre argued that intellectuals, as well as ordinary citizens, are responsible for taking a stand on the major political conflicts of their era (What is Literature? p. 38). Somewhat idealistically, he hoped that literature might be a vehicle through which oppressed minorities could gain group consciousness, and through which members of the elite would be provoked into action.

Sartre was famous for writing scathing essays condemning French policies. While he intervened in most major French political issues in his lifetime, his critique of French colonialism in Algeria is the most striking instance of Sartrean engagement. He wrote dozens of essays attacking French colonialism in Algeria, and introduced to the French public works of lesser known political writers. Sartre wrote prefaces for F. Fanon’s study of psychic pathologies caused under French colonialism, Wretched of the Earth (Les damnés de la terre, 1961), H. Alleg’s book on torture in Algeria, The Question (La question, 1958), and A. Memmi’s Colonized and Colonizer (Portrait du colonisé, 1957). His preface to an anthology of black, anti-colonialist poets, A. Césaire and L. Senghor’s “Black Orpheus” (“Orphée Noir,” 1948), extended his theory of engaged literature and contributed to the Negritude movement.

The inaugural issue of Les Temps modernes (October, 1945) first articulated the vision of social responsibility which would become the hallmark of political existentialism. A socially responsible writer must address the major events of the era, take a stance against injustice and work to alleviate oppression. What is Literature? (Qu’est-ce que la literature?, 1947) bases the argument for responsible writing on a phenomenological description of the relationship between reader and writer. Writing is necessarily a dialogical, intersubjective process, where author and reader mutually recognize each other (What is Literature?, p. 58). Mutual respect, Sartre claims, is inherent in the relationship between artist and audience. What is Literature? is a landmark essay because it provides the social-ontological basis for Sartre’s view of mutual recognition and grounds his claim that authentic, engaged action must respect the needs of others.

Sartre’s claim that engagement is an ethical and political virtue begins with the premise that humans are necessarily situated in particular places and times. It is impossible to be politically neutral, he insists (What is Literature?, p. 38). The only honest course is to openly admit and defend one’s political commitments. Engagement is the political version of existential authenticity, which requires affirming one’s freedom within a social context. Authenticity is a wider notion than engagement, since authenticity requires awareness and responsibility with respect to the totality of one’s being, and overcoming bad faith globally. Existential engagement, on the other hand, requires political awareness and responsibility, and overcoming bad faith with respect to political issues.

Sartrean engagement can be usefully compared to common conceptions of moral responsibility. Sartre accepts the notion that a person should be held morally responsible for an action that she intentionally causes. The distinguishing mark of Sartre’s view is his broad extension of the notion of causal responsibility. Sartre holds an extremely demanding view of negative responsibility (responsibility for omissions). Passivity, Sartre claims, is equivalent to activity (Being and Nothingness, p. 707; What is Literature?, pp. 38, 232 and 234; Notebooks, p. 490). Any omitted action is an action for which an agent is culpable. In a variety of works, Sartre uses the case of war to illustrate his view. If I am the citizen of a nation at war then the war is “mine” and I bear a direct, personal responsibility for the action of my government. Sartre’s essay “We Are All Assassins” (“Nous sommes tous des assassins,” 1958) epitomizes his view: average French citizens are all equally culpable for the French government’s action of enforcing the death penalty.

In late works like Critique Sartre combines a demanding account of personal responsibility with the functionalist view that individuals incarnate their environment. The result is a portrait of social responsibility that holds average citizens responsible for diffuse social ills like racism, poverty, colonialism and sexism. Despite the fact that Sartre fell short of offering a detailed analysis of negative responsibility which would vindicate his sometimes exaggerated ascription of individual moral liability for collective harms, his portrait of political responsibility remains one of the most powerful of the twentieth century.

6. Ideal Society

While never presenting a complete portrait of his ideal society (whether in fiction or non-fiction), Sartre was a lifelong advocate of socialism. In interviews late in life Sartre allowed himself to be called an “anarchist” and a “libertarian socialist” (See “Interview with Jean-Paul Sartre” in The Philosophy of Jean-Paul Sartre, ed. P.A. Schilpp, p. 21.). Sartre hoped for a society based on two principles: individual freedom and the elimination of material scarcity.

In Notebooks Sartre described himself as developing a “concrete ethics” which would combine normative ethics and political theory (p. 104). The closest equivalent is Hegel’s notion of Sittlichkeit (ethical life), as described in Philosophy of Right. Like Hegel, Sartre claimed that ethics is more a matter of social convention than abstract rule following. Ethics must be lived in the everyday institutions of average citizens. The natural law approach to ethics, Kantianism in particular, is of limited value because of its universal, abstract character. Sartre accepted the Kantian injunction “always treat others as ends” but he vehemently rejected the existence of a single set of inflexible moral commandments governing all ethical situations (Notebooks, p. 258).

By contrast, Sartre wrote favorably of Hegelian ethics. Mirroring Hegel in Philosophy of Right, Sartre claimed that genuinely ethical relations arise from mutual recognition (Notebooks, pp. 274-279). Kant’s formulaic humanism, Sartre claimed, would strip individuals of their particularity. The real source of ethical injunctions—namely, other people—would be obscured behind notions of transcendental human nature and natural law.

In the late 1940’s Sartre coined the term “concrete liberalism” to describe the type of society he favored (Anti-Semite and Jew, p. 147). The main feature of concrete liberalism is that the fundamental regulative ideal of society—mutual respect—would be based on an individual’s particular projects, not on her abstract human nature (Notebooks, p. 140). Rights, for example, would be guaranteed because of a person’s “active participation in the life of society” not by appealing to a “problematical and abstract ‘human nature’” (Anti-Semite and Jew, p. 146). Sartre’s view anticipates the postmodern critique of Enlightenment values such as universal respect.

In Critique Sartre developed a group theory that is consistent with anarchistic-socialism, although he did not explicitly endorse anarchy in that work. The state, Sartre claimed, cannot represent the people because the people are a collective not a group (Critique, pp. 635-42). Only genuine groups can be represented. (Think, for example, of a labor union which has explicit mechanisms for forming policies and collective views). Modern industrialized societies consist of alienated, serially dispersed citizens. In Critique Sartre recommended, implicitly at least, a loose federation of democratically self-organized groups.

In short, ideal society for Sartre would likely consist of an anarchistic-socialist order where individuals would have the resources to pursue their own authentically chosen projects, with little interference from the state or other entrenched powers. Special emphasis would be placed on local, democratic groups which would support the freely chosen projects of authentic individuals.

7. Conclusion

Sartre’s contributions to twentieth century political philosophy are substantial. Sartre developed a unique political vocabulary that combined the personal redemption of existential authenticity with a call for systematic social change. Like Hegel, Sartre argued that freedom is the most central normative value and sought to reconcile the pursuit of individual freedom with the need for social institutions. Sartre’s analysis of colonialism, racism and anti-Semitism eloquently bridged the gap between theory and practice, and significantly enriched the categories of traditional Marxism. Justifiably, Sartre will be long remembered as both a systematic political philosopher and a trenchant social critic.

8. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

The following is a shortlist of Sartre’s most important political works which have been translated into English.

Anti-Semite and Jew. New York: Schocken, 1988.
- Sartre’s classic analysis of anti-Semitism and his longest discussion of existential authenticity.
Between Existentialism and Marxism. New York: William Morrow and Company, 1974.
- Includes several pivotal political essays including “A Plea for Intellectuals.”
Colonialism and Neocolonialism. London: Routledge, 2001.
- A collection of anti-Colonial writings. Includes Sartre’s preface to F. Fanon’s Wretched of the Earth.
Communists and the Peace. New York: George Braziller, 1968.
- Statement of Sartre’s brief alignment with the French Communist Party.
“The Condemned of Altona.” New York: Knopf, 1961.
- Explores collective responsibility for the holocaust.
Critique of Dialectical Reason, Volume 1. London: Verso, 2004.
- The principle theoretical text of Sartrean Existentialist-Marxism. Articulates Sartre’s theory of groups and history.
Critique of Dialectical Reason, Volume 2. London: Verso, 1991.
- Unfinished volume devoted to the question of whether history can be understood as the result of group struggle.
“Existentialism is a Humanism” in Existentialism. New York: Philosophical Library, 1947.
- Famous speech in which Sartre suggests that existentialism has an ethics, not unlike Kant’s categorical imperative.
Ghost of Stalin. New York: George Braziller, 1968.
- Published in 1956, announces Sartre’s break with the French Communist Party over the Soviet invasion of Hungary.
Hope Now: The 1980 Interviews. Chicago: University of Chicago, 1996.
- Interviews conducted by young Maoist Beny Lévy in the last year of Sartre’s life, suggesting a new Sartrean ethics.
Life/Situations: Essays Written and Spoken. New York: Pantheon, 1977.
- Contains several important political essays including “Elections: A Trap for Fools.”
“Materialism and Revolution” in Literary and Philosophical Essays. New York: Crowell-Collier, 1962.
- Describes the liberating potential of human work.
Notebooks for an Ethics. Chicago: University of Chicago, 1992.
- Posthumously published set of notebooks exploring existential ethics and politics. Includes long discussions of oppression, slavery, Hegel’s master/slave dialectic and Marxism.
No Exit and Three Other Plays. New York: Vintage Books, 1946.
- Contains “The Flies,” which is a parable about freedom, and “Dirty Hands,” which deals with the ethics of revolutionary violence.
On Genocide. Boston: Beacon Press, 1968.
- Short article on the American war in Vietnam and the legacy of French colonialism.
Saint Genet: Actor and Martyr. New York: George Braziller, 1971.
- Sartre’s existential biography of French writer and thief Jean Genet.
Sartre On Cuba. New York: Ballantine Books, 1961.
- Report of Sartre’s visit to post-revolution Cuba.
Search for a Method. New York: Vintage Books, 1963.
- Introduction to the longer Critique. Best succinct statement of Sartrean Existentialist-Marxism.
What Is Literature? and Other Essays. Cambridge: Harvard University Press, 1988.
- The canonical statement of Sartrean engaged literature. Contains “Black Orpheus,” a defense of the “negritude” poetry of Césaire and Senghor, as well as the inaugural essay for Sartre’s journal Les Temps modernes.

b. Secondary Sources

The following secondary sources on Sartre’s political and ethical thinking are also recommended.

Anderson, Thomas C., 1993, Sartre’s Two Ethics: From Authenticity to Integral Humanity, Chicago: Open Court.
Anderson, Thomas C., 1979, The Foundation and Structure of Sartrean Ethics, Lawrence: Regents Press of Kansas.
Aron, Raymond, 1975, History and The Dialectic of Violence: An Analysis of Sartre’s Critique de la Raison Dialectique, New York: Harper and Row.
Aronson, Ronald, 1987, Sartre’s Second Critique, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
Bell, Linda A., 1989, Sartre’s Ethics of Authenticity, Tuscaloosa: University of Alabama Press.
Catalano, Joseph, 1986, A Commentary on Jean-Paul Sartre’s Critique of Dialectical Reason, vol. 1, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
Charmé, Stuart Zane, 1991, Vulgarity and Authenticity: Dimensions of Otherness in the World of Jean-Paul Sartre, Amherst: University of Mass Press.
Chiodi, Pietro, 1978, Sartre and Marxism, Sussex: Harvester.
Detmer, David, 1988, Freedom as a Value: A Critique of the Ethical Theory of Jean-Paul Sartre, La Salle: Open Court.
Dobson, Andrew, 1993, Jean-Paul Sartre and the Politics of Reason, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Flynn, Thomas R., 1984, Sartre and Marxist Existentialism: The Test Case of Collective Responsibility, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
Flynn, Thomas R., 1997, Sartre, Foucault and Historical Reason, vol. 1: Toward an Existentialist Theory of History, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
Heter, T. Storm, 2006, Sartre’s Ethics of Engagement: Authenticity and Civic Virtue, London: Continuum.
Jeanson, Francis, 1981, Sartre and the Problem of Morality, tr. Robert Stone, Bloomington: Indiana University Press.
Martin, Thomas, 2002, Oppression and the Human Condition: An Introduction to Sartrean Existentialism, Lanham: Rowman and Littlefield.
McBride, William Leon, 1991, Sartre’s Political Theory, Bloomington: Indiana University Press.
Merleau-Ponty, Maurice, 1973, Adventures of the Dialectic, trans. Joseph Bien, Evanston: Northwestern University Press.
Murphy, Julien S. (ed), 1999, Feminist Interpretations of Jean-Paul Sartre, University Park: Pennsylvania State University Press.
Santoni, Ronald E., 2003, Sartre on Violence: Curiously Ambivalent, University Park: Pennsylvania State University Press.
Stone, Robert and Elizabeth Bowman, 1986, “Dialectical Ethics: A First Look at Sartre’s unpublished 1964 Rome Lecture Notes,” Social Text nos. 13-14 (Winter-Spring, 1986), 195-215.
Stone, Robert and Elizabeth Bowman, 1991, “Sartre’s ‘Morality and History’: A First Look at the Notes for the unpublished 1965 Cornell Lectures” in Sartre Alive, ed. Ronald Aronson and Adrian van den Hoven, Detroit: Wayne State University Press, 53-82.

Author Information

Storm Heter
Email: sheter@po-box.esu.edu
East Stroudsburg University
U. S. A.

Yinyang (Yin-yang)

Yinyang (yin-yang) is one of the dominant concepts shared by different schools throughout the history of Chinese philosophy. Just as with many other Chinese philosophical notions, the influences of yinyang are easy to observe, but its conceptual meanings are hard to define. Despite the differences in the interpretation, application, and appropriation of yinyang, three basic themes underlie nearly all deployments of the concept in Chinese philosophy: (1) yinyang as the coherent fabric of nature and mind, exhibited in all existence, (2) yinyang as jiao (interaction) between the waxing and waning of the cosmic and human realms, and (3) yinyang as a process of harmonization ensuring a constant, dynamic balance of all things. As the Zhuangzi (Chuang-tzu) claims, “Yin in its highest form is freezing while yang in its highest form is boiling. The chilliness comes from heaven while the warmness comes from the earth. The interaction of these two establishes he (harmony), so it gives birth to things. Perhaps this is the law of everything yet there is no form being seen” (Zhuangzi, Chapter 21). In none of these conceptions of yinyang is there a valuational hierarchy, as if yin could be abstracted from yang (or vice versa), regarded as superior or considered metaphysically separated and distinct. Instead, yinyang is emblematic of valuational equality rooted in the unified, dynamic, and harmonized structure of the cosmos. As such, it has served as a heuristic mechanism for formulating a coherent view of the world throughout Chinese intellectual and religious history.

Origins of the Terms Yin and Yang
The Yinyang School
Yinyang as Qi (Vital Energy)
Yinyang as Xingzi (Concrete Substance)
The Yinyang Symbol
References and Further Reading

1. Origins of the Terms Yin and Yang

The earliest Chinese characters for yin and yang are found in inscriptions made on “oracle bones” (skeletal remains of various animals used in ancient Chinese divination practices at least as early as the 14th century B.C.E.). In these inscriptions, yin and yang simply are descriptions of natural phenomena such as weather conditions, especially the movement of the sun. There is sunlight during the day (yang) and a lack of sunlight at night (yin). According to the earliest comprehensive dictionary of Chinese characters (ca. 100 CE), Xu Shen’s Shuowen jiezi (Explaining Single-component Graphs and Analyzing Compound Characters), yin refers to “a closed door, darkness and the south bank of a river and the north side of a mountain.” Yang refers to “height, brightness and the south side of a mountain.” These meanings of yin and yang originated in the daily life experience of the early Chinese. Peasants depended on sunlight for lighting and their daily life routines. When the sun came out, they would go to the field to work; when the sun went down, they would return home to rest. This sun-based daily pattern evidently led to a conceptual claim: yang is movement (dong) and yin is rest (jing). In their earliest usages, yin and yang existed independently and were not connected. The first written record of using these two characters together appears in a verse from the Shijing (Book of Songs): “Viewing the scenery at a hill, looking for yinyang.” This indicates that yang is the sunny side and yin is the shady side of hill. This effect of the sun exists at the same time over the hill.

2. The Yinyang School

According to Sima Tan (Ssu-ma Tan, c. 110 B.C.E.), there existed a school of teaching during the “Spring and Autumn” (770-481 B.C.E.) and “Warring States” (403-221 B.C.E.) periods that bore the name of yinyang. He lists this yinyang school alongside five others (Confucian, Mohist, Legalist, Fatalist, and Daoist) and defines its theory as “the investigation of the shu [art] of yin and yang.” According to him, this school focused on omens of luck and explored the patterns of the four seasons. In other words, the yinyang school was concerned with methods of divination or astronomy (disciplines that were not distinct from one another in early China, as elsewhere in the ancient world) and the calendrical arts (which entailed study of the four seasons, eight locations, twelve du [measures] and twenty-four shijie [time periods]). Just as the Confucians (rujia) arose from the ranks of rushi (“scholar-gentlemen”) who excelled at ritual and music, those of the yingyang school came from the fangshi (“recipe-gentlemen”) who specialized in various numerological disciplines known as shushu (“number-arts”). These shushu included tianwen (astronomy), lipu (calendar-keeping), wuxing (“five phases” correlative theory), zhuguai (tortoise-shell divination), zazha (fortune-telling) and xingfa (face-reading). The Han dynasty chronicle Shiji (Records of the Historian) lists Zou Yan (305-240 B.C.E.) as a representative of the yinyang school who possessed a profound knowledge of the theory of yinyang and wrote about a hundred thousand words on it. However, none of his works have survived.

By the Han dynasty (202 B.C.E.-220 C.E.), yinyang was associated with wuxing (“five phases”) correlative cosmology. According to the “Great Plan” chapter of the Shujing (Classic of Documents), wuxing refers to material substances that have certain functional attributes: water is said to soak and descend; fire is said to blaze and ascend; wood is said to curve or be straight; metal is said to obey and change; earth is said to take seeds and give crops. Wuxing is used as a set of numerological classifiers and explains the configuration of change on various scales. The so-called yinyang wuxing teaching – an “early Chinese attempt in the direction of working out metaphysics and a cosmology” (Chan 1963: 245) – was a fusion of these two conceptual schemes applied to astronomy and the mantic arts.

3. Yinyang as Qi (Vital Energy)

The most enduring interpretation of yinyang in Chinese thought is related to the concept of qi (ch’i, vital energy). According to this interpretation, yin and yang are seen as qi (in both yin and yang forms) operating in the universe. In the “Duke Shao” chapter of the Zuozhuan (The Book of History), yin and yang are first defined as two of six heavenly qi:

There are six heavenly influences [qi] which descend and produce the five tastes, go forth in the five colours, and are verified in the five notes; but when they are in excess, they produce the six diseases. Those six influences are denominated the yin, the yang, wind, rain, obscurity, and brightness. In their separation, they form the four seasons; in their order, they form the five (elementary) terms. When any of them is in excess, they ensure calamity. An excess of the yin leads to diseases of cold; of the yang, to diseases of heat. (Legge 1994: 580).

Here, yin and yang are the qi of the universe. These qi flow within the natural as well as the human worlds. They are the basic fabric of existence:

Heaven and earth have their regular ways, and men like these for their pattern, imitating the brilliant bodies of Heaven, and according with the natural diversities of the Earth. (Heaven and Earth) produce the six atmospheric conditions [qi], and make use of the five material elements. Those conditions (and elements) become the five tastes, are manifested in the five colours, and displayed in the five notes. When they are in excess, there ensue obscurity and confusion, and people lose their (proper) nature… There were mildness and gentleness kindness and harmony, in imitation of the producing and nourishing action of Heaven. There are love and hatred, pleasure and anger, grief and joy, produced by the six atmosphere conditions [qi]. Therefore (the sage kings) carefully imitated these relations and analogies (in forming ceremonies), to regulate those six impulses…When there is no failure in the joy and grief, we have a state in harmony with the nature of Heaven and Earth, which consequently can endure long. ( Legge 1994: 708).

Thus qi, a force arising from the interplay between yin and yang, becomes a context in which yinyang is seated and functions. Yinyang as qi provides an explanation of the beginning of the universe and serves as a building block of the Chinese intellectual tradition. In many earlier texts, one may observe how yinyang generates a philosophical perspective on heaven, earth and human beings. Chapter 42 of the Laozi says that “everything is embedded in yin and embraces yang; through chong qi [vital energy] it reaches he [harmony].” It is through yinyang’s function as qi and the interaction between them that everything comes into existence. Zhuangzi also speaks about the “qi of yin and yang”: “When the qi of yin and yang are not in harmony, and cold and heat come in untimely ways, all things will be harmed.” (Zhuangzi ch. 31) On the other hand, “when the two have successful intercourse and achieve harmony, all things will be produced.” (Zhuangzi ch. 21)

The interpretation of yinyang as qi conceives yinyang as a dynamic and natural form of flowing energy, a complementary in the primordial potency of the universe. The Huainanzi offers more detailed explanation of the cosmological process of yin and yang:

When heaven and earth were formed, they divided into yin and yang. Yang is generated [sheng] from yin and yin is generated from yang. Yin and yang mutually alternate which makes four fields [wei, “celestial circles”] penetrate. Sometimes there is life, sometimes there is death, that brings the myriad things to completion. (ch. 2)

This process also explains the beginning of human life. When qi moved, the clear and light rose to be heaven and the muddy and heavy fell to become earth. When these two qi interacted and attained the stage of harmony (he), human life began. This shows that everything is made from the same materials and difference relies on the interaction.

Qi also takes on various forms and is convertible from one form to another with order and pattern. The concept of yinyang supplies a unitary vision of heaven, earth and human beings and makes the world intelligible in terms of a resonance between human beings and the universe. The Guoyu (Discourses of the States) describes how earthquakes took place at the confluence of the Jing, Wei, and Lou rivers during the second year of Duke You of the western Zhou dynasty. A certain Boyang Fu claims that the Zhou empire is doomed to collapse, explaining that

The qi of heaven and earth can’t lose its order. If its order vanishes people will be disoriented. Yang was stuck and could not get out, yin was suppressed and could not evaporate, so an earthquake was inevitable. Now the earthquakes around the three rivers are due to yang losing its place and yin being pressed down. Yang is forsaken under yin so the source of rivers has been blocked. If the foundation of rivers is blocked the country will definitely collapse. This is because of the fact that the flowing water and flourishing land are necessities for the people’s lives. If the water and land cannot sustain the people’s living conditions, the country will inevitably fall. (Discourse of the States 1994: 22).

Not only does this ¬yinyang-flavored explanation claim to illuminate natural phenomena, it also implies that there is an intrinsic relationship between natural events and political systems. Human beings, especially political leaders, must align their virtuous actions with the morally-oriented universe. If they follow and harmonize with (shun) the order and patterns of the universe, they will be rewarded with prosperity and flourishing, but if they go against and conflict with (ni) it, they will be punished with disasters and destruction. Whether one engages in shun or ni depends upon whether yin and yang are in a state of balance. Thus, yinyang provides a heuristic outlook for human understanding as well as ethical guidance for achieving harmony in action. As chapter 8 of the Huainanzi claims:

Yinyang embodies the harmony of heaven and earth, manifests the forms of myriad things, contains qi to transform the things and completes various kinds of things; yinyang extends and penetrates to the deepest level; begins in emptiness then becomes full and moves in boundless lands.

4. Yinyang as Xingzi (Concrete Substance)

Yinyang also has been understood as some concrete substance (xingzhi), according to which yixing and yangxing define everything in the universe. In the Yijing (I-Ching, The Book of Changes), yinyang is presented as xingzhi. Yang was identified with the sun and yin with the moon:

Heaven and earth correlate with vast and profound; four seasons correlate with change and continuity [biantong]; the significance of yin and yang correlate with sun and moon; the highest excellence [zhide] correlates the goodness of easy and simple.(Sishu wujing 1990: 197)

The Guanzi, an important work of the Huang-Lao school, discusses this view along the same lines: “The sun is in charge of yang, the moon is in charge of yin, the stars are in charge of harmony [he].” (Guanzi 2000: 151). This xingzhi interpretation materializes the concept of yinyang in some concrete contexts and shows that the universe is orderly, moral and gendered. The pattern of the world is written in a gendered language. Yinyang is something one can see, feel, and grasp through the senses. For example, in the Liji (Book of Ritual), music represents the he (harmony) of heaven and earth, while li (ritual) represents the order of heaven and earth: “Music is coming from yang, ritual is coming from yin. The harmony of yinyang receives the myriad things.” (Sishu wujing 1990: 525) In the human world, male as yang should be cultivated, otherwise the day will suffer; female as yin should be cultivated too, otherwise the moon will be affected.

According to Dong Zhongshu, (195-115 B.C.E.), both Tian (heaven) and human beings have yinyang. Therefore, there is an intrinsic connection between tian and human beings through the movement of yin and yang. Yinyang is an essential vehicle for interactions between heaven and human beings: “The qi of yinyang moves heaven above as well as in human beings. When it is among human beings it is displayed itself as like, dislike, happy and mad, when it is in heaven it is seen as warm, chilly, cold and hot.” (Dong Zhongshu 1996: 436) In Dong’s cosmological vision, the whole universe is a giant yinyang. One of many examples of this vision is Dong’s proposal to control floods and prevent droughts by proper human interaction. In chapter 74 (“Seeking the Rain”) of his Luxuriant Gems of the Spring and Autumn, Dong asserts that a spring drought indicates too much yang and not enough yin. So one should “open yin and close yang” (1996: 432) He suggests that the government should have the south gate closed, which is in the direction of yang. Men, embodying yang, should remain in seclusion. Women, embodying yin, should appear in public. He even requests all married couples to copulate (ouchu) to secure more yinyang intercourse. It is also important during this time to make women happy. (1996: 436) In chapter 75 (“Stopping the Rain”), Dong alleges that the flood proves there is too much yin so one should “open yang and close yin” (1996: 438). The north gate, the direction of yin, should be wide open. Women should go into concealment and men should be visible. Officers in the city should send their wives to the countryside in order to make sure that yin will not conquer yang. Derk Bodde defines this practice as a “sexual sympathetic magic.” (Bodde 1981: 373)

Finally, yinyang also plays a pivotal role in traditional Chinese thought about health and the human body. The early medical text known as the Huangdi neijing (The Yellow Emperor’s Classic of Internal Medicine) provides a detailed account of physiological functions and pathological changes in the body and guidance for diagnosis and treatment in terms of yinyang. Five zang (organs) — the kidneys, liver, heart, spleen and lungs — are classified as yin. They control the storage of vital substance and qi. Six fu (organs) — the gallbladder, stomach, small and large intestines, urinary bladder and triple burner (referring to three parts of the body cavity: the upper burner, which houses the heart and lungs; the middle burner, which houses the spleen and stomach; and the lower burner, which houses the kidney, urinary bladder and small and large intestines) — are yang and control the transport and digestion of food. The storage is a yin function, and the transport and transformation of substance is a yang function. But the zang and fu organs can be further subdivided into yin and yang. The activity or function of each organ is its yang aspect, while its substance is its yin aspect. Yin should flow smoothly and yang should vivify steadily. They regulate themselves so as to maintain equilibrium. Yin and yang do not exist in isolation but are in a dynamic state in which they interact and fashion the complicated and intricate system of the human body.

5. The Yinyang Symbol

There is no a clear and definite way to determine the exact date of origin or the person who created the popular yinyang symbol. No one has ever claimed specific ownership of this popular image. However, there is a rich textual and visual history leading to its creation. Inspired by a primeval vision of cosmic harmony, Chinese thinkers have sought to codify this order in various intellectual constructions. Whether to formulate this underlying pattern through words and concepts or numbers and visual images has been debated since the Han dynasty. The question first surfaced in the interpretation of the Yijing. The Yijing is constructed around sixty-four hexagrams (gua), each of which is made of six parallel broken or unbroken line segments (yao). Each of the sixty-four hexagrams has a unique designation; its image (xiang) refers to a particular natural object and conveys the meaning of human events and activities. The Yijing thus has generated a special way to decipher the universe. It mainly incorporates three elements: xiang (images), shu (numbers), and li (meanings). They act as the mediators between heavenly cosmic phenomena and earthly human everyday life. From the Han dynasty through the Ming and Qing dynasties (1368-1912 CE), there was a consistent tension between two schools of thought: the school of xiangshu (images and numbers) and the school of yili (meanings and reasoning). At issue between them is how best to interpret the classics, particularly the Yijing. The question often was posed as: “Am I interpreting the six classics or are the six classics interpreting me?”

For the school of Xiangshu the way to interpret the classics is to produce a figurative and numerological representation of the universe through xiang (images) and shu (numbers). It held that xiangshu are indispensable structures expressing the Way of heaven, earth and human being. Thus the school of Xiangshu takes the position that “I interpret the classics” by means of the images and numbers. The emphasis is on the appreciation of classics. The school of Yili, on the other hand, focuses on an exploration of the meanings of the classics on the basis of one’s own reconstruction. In other word, the school of Yili treats all classics as supporting evidence for their own ideas and theories. The emphasis is more on idiosyncratic new theories rather than the explanation of the classics. In what follows, our inquiry focuses on the legacy of the Xiangshu school.

The most common effort of the Xiangshu school was to draw tu (diagrams). Generations of intellectuals labored on the formulation and creation of numerous tu. Tu often delineate structure, place, and numbers through black and white lines. They are not aesthetic objects but rather serve as a means of articulating the fundamental patterns that govern phenomena in the universe. Tu are universes in microcosm and demonstrate obedience to definite norms or rules. During the Song dynasty (960-1279 CE), the Daoist monk Chen Tuan (906-989 CE) made an important contribution to this tradition by drawing a few tu in order to elucidate the Yijing. Though none of his tu were directly passed down, he is considered the forerunner of the school of tushu (diagrams and writings). It is said that he left behind three tu; since his death, attempting to discover these tu has become a popular scholarly pursuit. After Chen Tuan, three trends in making tu emerged, exemplified by the work of three Neo-Confucian thinkers: the Hetu (Diagram of River) and Luoshu (Chart of Luo) ascribed to Liu Mu (1011-1064 CE), the Xiantian tu (Diagram of Preceding Heaven) credited to Shao Yong (1011-1077 CE), and the Taijitu (Diagram of the Great Ultimate) attributed to Zhou Dunyi (1017-1073 CE). These three trends eventually led to the creation of the first yinyang symbol by Zhao Huiqian (1351-1395 CE), entitled Tiandi Zhiran Hetu (Heaven and Earth’s Natural Diagram of the River) and pictured above at the head of this entry.

6. References and Further Reading

Bennett, Steven J. “Patterns of the Sky and the Earth: A Chinese Science of Applied Cosmology.” Chinese Science (March 1978) 3: 1-26.
Chan, Wing-tsit, ed. A Source Book in Chinese Philosophy. Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press, 1963.
Bodde, Derk. Essays on Chinese Civilization. Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press, 1981.
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Author Information

Robin R. Wang
Email: rwang@lmu.edu
Loyola Marymount University
U. S. A.

Evolutionary Epistemology

Evolutionary Epistemology (EE) is a naturalistic approach to epistemology and so is part of philosophy of science. Other naturalistic approaches include sociological, historical and anthropological explanations of knowledge. What makes EE specific is that it subscribes to the idea that cognition is to be understood primarily as a product of biological evolution. What does this mean exactly? Biological evolution is regarded as the precondition of the variety of cognitive, cultural, and social behavior that an organism, group or species can portray. In other words, biological evolution precedes (socio-)cultural (co-)evolution. Conversely, (socio-)cultural (co-)evolution originates as a result of biological evolution. Therefore:

EE studies the origin, evolution and current mechanisms of all cognitive capacities of all biological organisms from within biological (evolutionary) theory. Here cognition is broadly conceived, ranging from the echolocation of bats, to human-specific symbolic thinking;
Besides studying the cognitive capacities themselves, EE investigates the ways in which biological evolutionary models can be used to study the products of these cognitive capacities. The cognitive products studied include, for example, the typical spatiotemporal perception of objects of all mammals, or more human-specific cognitive products such as science, culture and language. These evolutionary models are at minimum applied on a descriptive level, but can also be used as explanations for the behavior under study. In other words, the cognitive mechanisms and their products are understood to be either comparative with, or the result of, biological evolution.
Within EE it is sometimes assumed that biological evolution itself is a cognitive process.

Overview
Context of Use
1. EE and Selection Theory
2. The EEM and EET Program
EE and Naturalized Epistemology
Different EEs: The Units and Levels of Selection Debate
The Environment, the Adaptationist Program and Traditional EE
1. The Adaptationist Program
2. Traditional EE
Evolution from the Point of View of the Organism
1. The Constructivist Approach
2. The Non-Adaptationist Approach within EE
Evolution from the Point of View of Genes
Universal Selection Mechanisms Repeated and Extended
References and Further Reading

1. Overview

A general account of the meaning and history of the term “evolutionary epistemology” is given in sections 1 and 2 below. It is important to understand in advance that different kinds of evolutionary epistemology (EE) can be distinguished, but all forms share the following assumption: that cognition, to a greater or lesser extent, needs to be studied from within evolutionary theory. Disagreements arise about:

where to draw the line between the cognitive and the non-cognitive,
which aspects of cognition should be studied from within evolutionary theory, and
which aspects of evolutionary theory should apply to the study of cognition.

Evolutionary theory itself is far from synonymous with the theory of evolution by natural selection. Rather, heterogeneous views on evolution arise when one takes the units and levels of selection debate (sections 3 through 6) as points of departure. Different perspectives on evolution emerge when one looks at evolution from the point of the environment (section 4), the organism (section 5), and genes (section 6). The development of different EEs parallels this perspectivism. That is, based on these different viewpoints, different EEs have been put forward. The adaptationist approach to evolution is the basis of traditional EE. Non-adaptationist approaches to EE have been based on the constructivist approach to evolution. The “gene’s eye view” of evolution has resulted in a quest for universal evolutionary epistemological mechanisms.

2. Context of Use

The concept “evolutionary epistemology” was first introduced by Donald T. Campbell (1974). However, he repeatedly refused to be called the founding father of EE since he saw himself as denoting “… something that has sprung up all over for a hundred years or more” (Campbell in Callebaut, 1993: 289).

If EE were to have a motto, it might come from Michael Ruse’s (1988) famous book title Taking Darwin Seriously. This means that when one adheres to an evolutionary view of life, one needs to understand all biological processes not only as the outcome of evolution, but also as something that can only be investigated adequately by making use of evolutionary theory.

Evolutionary epistemology understands epistemology to be a product of biological evolution. Therefore, epistemology is studied from within evolutionary biology. Cognition is no longer understood to be linguistic (propositional) or a human-bounded characteristic. Rather, all organisms can show behavior that is cognitively based.

Hence, the first major quest of evolutionary epistemologists is distinguishing between the different cognitive processes that biological organisms from all major kingdoms of life can display.

Second, they investigate how these cognitive capacities evolved from unicellular organisms onwards.

Third, the products of cognition (on the one hand, the perception of light, or color, on the other hand, science, culture and language) are understood from within an evolutionary approach.

The use of biological theories and mechanisms to comprehend cognition is either meant to be descriptive or explanatory. In this context, Ruse (1988: 32) differentiates between an “analogy-as-heuristic” and an “analogy-as-justification.” The former term refers to using metaphors and analogies from evolutionary theory to describe, for example, the evolution of science loosely and to discover new approaches to research. The latter research strategy involves applying evolutionary analogies to justify and thus to validate such things as the evolution of science.

In sum, the underlying view of EE is thus that there is a universal evolutionary mechanism that lead first to the evolution of life in general, and second, that this mechanism is also at work within the evolution of cognition, and within the products of cognition such as language, science and culture.

Some evolutionary epistemologists such as Campbell (1974), therefore also assume that this evolutionary mechanism in its own workings portrays an evolutionary mechanism. This concept will be discussed later.

The concept “EE” today is commonly used as a synonym for selection theory on the one hand, and, on the other hand, as part of the EEM and EET program.

a. EE and Selection Theory

EE has strong affinities with selection theory (Campbell, 1997). The latter is a theory that adheres to the view that all and only selectionist, as opposed to instructionist (behaviorist) — explanations of an organism’s traits (including cognitive ones) are valid. Behaviorist explanations state that it suffices to describe the visible, external behavior that an organism portrays in order to develop adequate explanations of that behavior. Selectionist accounts, by contrast, also examine internal elements that underlie a certain trait (such as genes, for example) and the evolutionary emergence of that trait. The term selection theory was first introduced by Simmel and Baldwin in the 19th century (Campbell, 1997). Today, however, a wide range of biologists, neurologists, and evolutionary epistemologists are selectionists (for an example, see Cziko 1995), but these scholars do not recognize or accept any direct influence of Simmel and Baldwin’s selection theory.

Throughout this article, the more general term EE is maintained. The reason is twofold. First, not all topics that are investigated by selectionists are relevant for the study of cognition. Second, not every Evolutionary Epistemologist defends a solely selectionist account of cognition. Rather, other evolutionary principles such as self-organization, for example, are also included to comprehend (the products of) cognition (as will be discussed in section 5). Finally, analogies are not only drawn between evolutionary theory and the evolution of science and knowledge. Culture, language, economics etc. can also be interpreted from within these evolutionary epistemological frameworks.

b. The EEM and EET Program

A useful distinction within EE is made by Bradie (1986). Two different programs are identified, the EEM and the EET program. Within the Evolution of Epistemological Mechanisms, the evolution of cognition and cognitive knowledge mechanisms is investigated from within the Modern Synthesis. The Modern Synthesis is the standard paradigm within evolutionary biology on how evolution occurs. This is based on the principle of evolution by natural selection as first introduced by Charles Darwin.

Furthermore, the products of cognitive evolution, such as language, science, or culture, are also understood to be the result of biological evolution, and it is assumed that in their emergence or structure an evolutionary pattern can also be found. The following example can illustrate this: the evolution of language or culture is at least partly the result of biological evolution. Hence, the same evolutionary mechanisms that are used to describe the evolution of cognition are also applicable to the products of cognition, such as language or culture. The EET program (Bradie, 1986) was introduced specifically for epistemological or scientific theories. The ways in which analogies are drawn between the evolution of science on the one hand and natural selection on the other are investigated within Evolution of Epistemological Theories.

Different evolutionary epistemologists are active within the above mentioned various fields and within extra-philosophical scientific fields, which makes it difficult to pinpoint the common assertions made by all evolutionary epistemologists. Adherents of an EEM position, for example, can object to the widely subscribed idea that science also needs to be explained from within evolutionary epistemology, as adherents of the EET program state. What binds evolutionary epistemologists is the idea that evolutionary theory, to some extent, can explain aspects of cognition.

3. EE and Naturalized Epistemology

What is so different about EE that it can be distinguished from all other epistemological endeavors? To answer this question, we need to first situate, and secondly, evaluate EE in relation to other philosophical frameworks.

EE is part of the naturalistic turn. The naturalistic turn itself is a larger movement that emphasizes the importance of a sociology of knowledge, anthropology of knowledge, and the historical study of knowledge. Evolutionary Epistemology in turn emphasizes the importance of the biology of knowledge. More specifically, the study of biological evolution is the precondition of all investigations into cognition (Wuketits, 1984: 2-19). Therefore, it explains evolution itself as a cognitive process.

Furthermore, within EE, knowledge and cognition are no longer conceived of as necessarily proposition-like or language-like or human-bounded. As such, EE stands opposed to traditional philosophical approaches to cognition (such as empiricist and rationalist ones that understand knowledge to be language-like), and it also goes beyond Quine’s Naturalized Epistemology. In order to understand this, first naturalized epistemology is briefly discussed and then the difference with EE is explained.

Naturalized epistemology was first introduced by Quine (1969), who stressed that the study of science and scientific thinking should revolve around how knowledge is processed, rather than what knowledge is in itself. Therefore, he emphasized that we should reject the idea of a first philosophy. Within a first philosophy, it is assumed that philosophy can make claims about science without using the sciences. If one would make use of the sciences, this would be understood as circular. Quine, however, stressed that we should investigate epistemology from within the natural sciences, more specifically, psychology:

The stimulation of his sensory receptors is all the evidence anybody has had to go on, ultimately, in arriving at his picture of the world. Why not see how this construction really proceeds? Why not settle for psychology?” (Quine, 1969: 269-70) […] [A]t this point it may be more useful to say that epistemology still goes on, though in a new setting and a clarified status. Epistemology, or something like it, simply falls into place as a chapter of psychology and hence of natural science. (Quine 1969: 273-4)

Epistemology is defined as that discipline which studies exactly how our sense organs construct a picture of the world. The study of knowledge involves the investigation into (1) the relation between neural input and observational sentences, and (2) an investigation into the relation between theoretical and observational sentences. Hence, according to Quine, knowledge, or more specifically, cognition, is still understood to be language-like: it is assumed that somehow our neural input is transformed into verbal output. A rather behaviorist position is taken by Quine, because the study of how our neurological abilities relate to language is not assessed. Somehow the relation between sensory input and language is assumed to be direct.

Neurology today, however, has shown us multiple times that at the neurological or cognitive level, there is no direct, and certainly no necessary relation between our categorizations and our language (Changeaux 1985; Gazzaniga 1994, 2000; Damasio 1996 and 1999; Ledoux 1998).

Furthermore, because of the rise of ethology and ecology (the study of the external behavior of animals in relation to their natural settings), cognition as a scientific concept has been broadened to include non-linguistic behavior as well.

It is here that evolutionary epistemology makes its entrée. Konrad Lorenz (1958) for example, was one of the founding fathers (together with Nikolas Tinbergen) of ethology. Lorenz stressed the importance of a cognitivist approach of behavior, hereby also including internal behavior.

In contrast to Naturalized Epistemology, EE does not only examine the relation between human, language-like knowledge and the world. Any type of relation that an organism engages in with its environment is understood as a knowledge relation, irrespective of whether or not these organisms have language.

Munz (2001: 9) points out that what makes EE unique is that knowledge is comprehended as a cognitive relation between an organism and its environment. Empiricists for example understood knowledge to be a relation between a knower and something knowable by induction, while rationalists define knowledge as a relation between a knower and something known because of deduction. Even within the sociology of knowledge movement, knowledge is not understood from within its relation between an organism and its environment, rather here it is comprehended as a relation between different knowers.

What makes EE different from all other naturalistic approaches within philosophy, is that it does not regard epistemology as a mere study of how a human knower comes to know what is knowable. Rather EE studies how knowledge about the environment is gained across different species, and what knowledge-gaining mechanisms arise in biological organisms through time enabling these organisms to cope with their environment. This means that within EE not only human cognition but all sorts of behavior that organisms at all levels in biological evolution display (ranging from instinctive behavior to cultural behavior or even chemotaxis – that is to say, communication between cells) are regarded as devices that are put to use to gain knowledge. And equally important, these mechanisms themselves are also comprehended as knowledge in and of themselves.

Within EE, contrary to behaviorism, internal factors that determine behavior and cognition are also included. Because biological evolution led to the rise and acquisition of different cognitive/knowledge processes, this evolution itself is explained as a knowledge process.

4. Different EEs: The Units and Levels of Selection Debate

The units and levels of selection debate is taken as the point of departure to distinguish between different types of EE. EEs draw on evolutionary theory to explain epistemology or cognition. However, there are disagreements on what evolution in general is. Therefore different, sometimes complementary evolutionary theories are put forward by evolutionary biologists. It is only logical that this results in different evolutionary epistemologies. Three different perspectives are described to understand evolution and the different EEs that arise when using these perspectives:

Evolution from the point of view of the environment, which lead to traditional, adaptationist approaches to EE;
Evolution from the point of view of the organism, which lead to non-adaptationist, constructivist approaches; and
Evolution from the point of view of genes, which opens the quest for universal selection formulas.

How did the units and levels of selection debate get started?

The Modern Synthesis (Ayala, 1978, Maynard-Smith, 1993, Mayr, 1978), which is the standard paradigm on how biological evolution occurs, states very strictly that the phenotype (the visible organism) is the unit of selection. This phenotype either is selected at the level of the environment, if this visible organism is adapted to that environment, or the organism dies out, if it is maladaptive.

With the rise of Postneodarwinian theory on the one hand, and Systems Theory on the other, the debate over the units and levels of selection was introduced first in biology, and later within evolutionary epistemology. In this discussion the primary question asked is whether there are units and levels of selection other than the phenotype and the environment. The concept “units of selection” was coined by the biologist Richard Lewontin in his famous homonymous article of 1970. The concept “levels of selection” was introduced by Robert Brandon in his 1982 article by the same name. However the discussion dates back to scientific debates concerning the possibility of group selection in the 1960s between William Hamilton (1964) and George C. Williams (1966, chapter 4), and still even further back in time to the 19th century when Herbert Spencer introduced and applied the “survival of the fittest” idea to human populations and society.

5. The Environment, the Adaptationist Program and Traditional EE

a. The Adaptationist Program

The concept “adaptationist program,” was first introduced by Gould and Lewontin (1979) — but is not subscribed to by these authors themselves. The adaptationist program regards “ […] natural selection as so powerful and the constraints upon it so few that direct production of adaptation through its operation becomes the primary cause of nearly all organic form, function, and behavior” (Gould and Lewontin, 1979:584-5).

To understand this, the distinction between ontogeny (the development of an organism from conception until death) and phylogeny (the evolution of species) is in order. Within Lamarckian theory, no strict separation between ontogenetic and phylogenetic processes is adhered to. Within this paradigm, also known as the inheritance of acquired characteristics, traits acquired during the lifetime of an individual can be passed on immediately to the next generation.

With the introduction of Darwin’s principle of natural selection, for the first time in history it was possible to distinguish between ontogenetic and phylogenetic processes, because of the distinction that is made between the inner and the outer world of the organism (Lewontin: 2000: 42-3). The inner milieu of the organism is, according to Darwin, subjected to, amongst other things, developmental growth processes that are not themselves subjected to evolution by natural selection. The outer environment, by contrast, is the sole scene where evolution by natural selection occurs. Here the environment either does or does not select an organism. Regarding the inner milieu of the organism, Darwin himself quite often made use of Lamarck’s theory. He used it as an explanation for how novel individual variation arises. Natural selection was never interpreted by Darwin as being the cause of the variation; in fact, he did not know how variation occurred. Therefore, he invoked Lamarck’s principle of the inheritance of acquired characteristics. Natural selection only selected amongst the given variation.

These ideas were later incorporated into the Modern Synthesis. Organisms vary. This variety is the result of, on the one hand, the specific combinations of genetic material that an organism carries, and on the other hand, possible random mutations that occur within these genes. One acquires the genetic material that one carries through birth, thus no child can choose its specific genetic code. And, the genetic mutations that sometimes occur, occur randomly, they are blind. That is to say, mutations are random errors that occurred during the copying of this genetic material. The genetic material that one carries can be neutral, adaptive or maladaptive for the carrier in the “struggle for existence.” The point, however, is that from this perspective, the organism itself cannot by any means whatsoever influence the genetic material that it carries. Eventually, it is the environment that indirectly selects adaptive organisms through the elimination of the unfit. Thus, the Modern Synthesis views this selection process as taking place between the phenotype and the environment. And the selection process itself is said to occur only externally: the “level of selection” is the external environment, and the selection of the “unit of selection,” the organism, occurs independently of internal processes such as developmental growth.

ev-ep-diagram1

Figure 1. The adaptationist approach focuses on the external relation
between the environment and the organism.

Thus, within the adaptationist approach the organism and the environment are conceived as two separate entities that only interact during the selection process but develop independently from one another (fig. 1).

Adaptation is literally the process of fitting an object to a pre-existing demand… Organisms adapt to the environment because the external world had acquired its properties independently of the organism, which must adapt or die. (Lewontin, 2000: 43)

In other words, Neodarwinian theory adheres to a strict dualistic viewpoint (Gontier, 2006) between organism and environment: the organism is passively selected, or not, by an active environment. The organism cannot influence its chances of survival or fitness. For this reason, according to Lewontin (1978), one can defend the position that because of the emphasis these scholars lay on adaptation, Neodarwinians explain evolution from the point of view of the environment. Hence, they actually give a description of the environment through the organism, rather than describing the organism itself.

b. Traditional EE

It is the latter position that has been one of the basic tenets of traditional EE, namely, that one is able to gain knowledge about the environment by studying the organisms that live in it, because organisms literally “re-present” the outer world.

What does this mean? Logical empiricism failed in providing a non-arbitrary relation between the world and human language. However, the search for such a non-arbitrary relation between the outer world and the organisms that inhabit that world was continued from within the adaptationist approach. In this position it is assumed that there is an unchangeable outer world to which organisms adapt. If it is true that organisms are adapted to the outer world, and that all and only the fit survive and reproduce in the long run, then these adaptive organisms can tell us something about that environment. An ant, for example, can tell us something about the soil.

This section provides an overview of the major traditional evolutionary epistemologies and how they developed out of the adaptationist view of evolution.

i. Karl Popper

Beginning with Sir Karl Popper’s (1963) ideas concerning conjectures and refutations (also called trials and errors), the following position is defended within traditional EE: there is a growth of (scientific) knowledge which is comparable with the succession of adaptations in evolution. The task of EE thus becomes explaining this growth.

Adhering to the strict distinction made between ontogeny and phylogeny, it is argued that at no stage during evolution does an organism receive knowledge from the outer world. Bold conjectures are made about the outer world and if these hypotheses are not falsified by experiments performed by the scientific community, they survive. In the long run, unfit theories are eliminated by the process of falsification, and there is a growth in knowledge. Theories that survive longer than others are understood to tentatively corroborate the truth. The analogy with biological evolution is clear: a selectionist account is preferred over an instructionist one. This means that at no point does an organism choose its genetic endowment. However, if this organism, with the genetic endowment that it is born with, stands the test of the environment, that is, if it survives long enough so that it can reproduce, than the organism‘s genetic traits survive, and it is said that it is adapted to its environment. In the long run, only the fit survive; maladaptive organisms are not able to survive long enough to reproduce and spread their genes in the gene pool again, and therefore die out.

Thus, just as the Modern Synthesis stresses that an organism can by no means directly receive instructions from the environment, Popper (1963: 46) emphasizes that we force our interpretations upon the world prior to our observations: “Without waiting, passively, for repetitions to impress regularities upon us, we actively try to impose regularities upon the world.” These are the conjectures that are put forward for trial, to be selected or eliminated according to the test-results. Scientific theories are thus not the result of observations, but of wild hypotheses. Although Popper himself is not part of the field of EE, his work on conjectures and refutations is often regarded as a first account on EE.

ii. Konrad Lorenz

Konrad Lorenz is also a representative of traditional EE, since he too worked within the adaptationist program. Lorenz (1941, 1985) is famous for reinterpreting Kant’s synthetic a priori claims. No longer are the inborn categories regarded as evidently true, rather, they are understood to be “ontogenetically a priori and phylogenetically a posteriori.” This means that an individual organism is born with innate dispositions. These innate dispositions are acquired phylogenetically, through the evolution of the species, by means of the mechanism of natural selection. Most importantly, these dispositions are fallible, because they are the result of selection, not instruction. That is, these dispositions are adaptations, and natural selection only weeds out maladaptive organisms, which results in the survival of the adaptive ones. According to the Modern Synthesis, at no time in evolution does natural selection actually cause or create the adaptive traits that are presented to the environment (again because of the strict distinction made between ontogeny, where natural selection does not work, and phylogeny, where it does.

According to Lorenz, and contrary to Kant, the thing in itself (Das Ding an Sich) is knowable through the categories of the knower, not the characteristics of the thing in itself, and selection results in a partial isomorphism through adaptation. Lorenz states that:

The central nervous apparatus does not prescribe the laws of nature any more than the hoof of the horse prescribes the form of the ground. Just as the hoof of the horse, this central nervous apparatus stumbles over unforeseen changes in its task. But just as the hoof of the horse is adapted to the ground of the steppe which it copes with, so our central nervous apparatus for organizing the image of the world is adapted to the real world with which man has to cope. (In Campbell, 1974: 447)

Thus, through adaptation, there is a correspondence between our images of the world and the world in itself, or between organism and environment, or between theories and the world. This is of course not a 1-to-1 correspondence; our image of a tree is not like a real tree, but because our cognitive apparatus is adapted to the world, there is a partial isomorphism between the two. Adaptations thus become a description of the world in a biological language (Lorenz, 1977).

The reinterpretation of Kant’s synthetic a priori claims is not solely the work of Lorenz; rather it dates as far back as Herbert Spencer. For the most complete overview of authors who have reinterpreted Kant’s ideas in this way, see Campbell (1974).

iii. Donald Campbell

Donald T. Campbell (1974) goes one step further than Lorenz because he rethought the distinction between ontogeny and phylogeny. No longer is natural selection something that solely works on the level of the environment; natural selection is internalized as well. Furthermore, the mechanism of natural selection, in its own workings, is said to work selectively as well.

Campbell’s (1959: 153-5) main goal was to develop an empirical science of induction (not to be confused with behaviorist instruction; see section 1). This empirical science consisted of a comparative study of the psychology of knowledge, a biological science of cognition, a sociology of knowledge, and a science of history. In other words, he wanted to build a science of science, which Campbell (1974) termed EE. This discipline had to be compatible with evolutionary biology and social evolution (Campbell, 1974: 413). In his 1959 paper he characterized biology as the study of “progressive adaptation.” Therefore, he made an abstraction of the mechanism of natural section by introducing the blind-variation-and-selective-survival mechanism (Campbell, 1959). Later he would call it the blind-variation-and-selective-retention scheme (Campbell (1960).

Campbell’s (1959: 156-8) EE is based upon six philosophical assumptions:

Hypothetical realism: EE acknowledges as a hypothesis the existence of an external world where entities exist and processes occur. This differs from Popper’s critical realism in that the existence of the world in itself also needs to be proven through observation.
No first philosophy: EE rejects the idea of a first philosophy, subscribing rather to the view that knowledge needs to be explained using scientific knowledge.
No distinction between human beings and animals is adhered to. On the contrary, it is fully acknowledged that human beings are animals.
EE is an “epistemology of the other one” as Campbell (1974: 448) calls it. This means that EE raises the question of how organisms come to know, not how a knower acquires knowledge. That is to say, it studies the relationship between an organism’s cognitive capacities and the environment that it is selected to cognize.
Epistemological dualism: there is a difference between what is knowable and what is known. Knowledge always constitutes indirect and fallible constructions that never completely correspond with the thing in itself.
Perspectivism: each of the different hypotheses that are formed provides another perspective. These can partially overlap, but also differ from one another. In the latter case, different positions can be regarded as equal.

According to Campbell, science was only one aspect of a general knowledge process and this process was hierarchical in nature. Knowledge is no longer merely language-like and human bounded. On the contrary, different biological and social layers can be distinguished which, each on its own, encompasses a different aspect of knowledge. And here too, the focus lies on the acquisition and growth of knowledge.

In his 1959 article, Campbell distinguishes between 12 knowledge processes. These include machines on the one hand, but also bisexuality, heterozygosis, and meiotic cell division, on the other. In his 1960 article Campbell discusses creative thinking as a separate learning process.

Finally, in his 1974 article he distinguishes ten different levels that are applicable to biological and social evolution. This is the last and most canonized hierarchy that Campbell (1974: 422-435) introduced and it are these ten levels that are now discussed.

(i) Non-mnemonic problem solving

Organisms that engage in non-mnemonic problem solving do not have a memory. Bacteria, for example, are such organisms. They blindly search for food until they find it: they cannot remember previous food sources, and they cannot voluntarily go to one. They are just swept away by the wind.

(ii) Vicarious locomotor devices

Examples are the echolocation of bats, or a blind man’s cane. They replace the blind exploration of the surrounding space by trial and error movements.

(iii) Habit and (iv) Instinct

Habit, instinct, and visual diagnosis are all closely related to each other, according to Campbell. Both instincts and habits are mostly founded upon visual stimuli that trigger a learned or innate response. Innate knowledge does not represent innate ideas; rather it corresponds to expectations or hypotheses that have no prior validity. Therefore, the distinction between “primitive instincts” and “learned habits” is false: all instincts are fine-tuned by learning processes and all learning makes use of inborn knowledge mechanisms. And both are hypotheses that need to be tested. Furthermore, Campbell introduces the popular habit-to-instinct view of his time, namely that by means of natural selection, habits will become instincts (without explaining how this takes place).

(v) Visually supported thought

This can be thought of as insightful problem-solving. Organisms endowed with this knowledge process are able to perform insightful behavior when they can visually perceive their surrounding environment. Campbell offers as an example the Köhler experiments, where primates are capable of showing some kind of “aha” experience.

(vi) Mnemonically supported thought

Organisms with memory capacities can re-present the environment, thereby replacing the need for a constant visually perceivable environment. Because one can imagine the environment, one can also have creative and intelligent thoughts, of unseen or unexperienced things (such as a mermaid).

(vii) Socially vicarious exploration: observational learning and imitation

Trial and error exploration by one member of the community can replace the trial and error exploration by all the other members of society. This is because certain organisms are able to learn by observing others. Imitating other’s behavior reduces the possibility that each individual on its own needs to invent a certain behavior. This implies that we live in a shared world; a solipsistic view is impossible. Campbell also stresses that learned behavior cannot jump from brain to brain; rather it needs to be learned in turn by trial and error. So a memetic position is not feasible in Campbell’s view.

(viii) Language

Language overlaps with (vi) and (vii) and is broadly conceived as including human language but also other communication systems such as bee language and pheromones. With language, the environment is represented by words that are contingently chosen (they don’t necessarily correspond with the world; the relation is indirect). Language acquisition too, does not merely encompass the direct passing on of words to children. Children, through trial and error, learn to correctly use the words they hear to describe certain objects and/or events, which again implies a strictly behavioristic model.

(ix) Cultural transmission

Changes in technology and culture also represent a blind variation and selective retention scheme. Complete social organizations or either selected or not and their respective leaders replace the behavior of the members of the community.

(x) Science

Science is part of cultural evolution. And also science reveals a trial and error pattern.

Many of the above mentioned knowledge mechanisms that Campbell introduced are today further divided or re-defined. Nevertheless it was Campbell who for the first time in history so clearly distinguished between different knowledge processes. Thus he showed that knowledge is not to be understood in a uniform manner.

Campbell’s more general blind-variation-and-selective-retention scheme, that is supposed to run through all levels of the hierarchy, is still applied today.

All increases in knowledge or adaptivity are an inductive process, and adaptivity is also comprehended as knowledge (Campbell, 1960). This differs from an instructionist process, because at no time is the organism a blank slate that is written upon by the environment. While natural selection does not cause blind variation, in a way it does cause indirect selective retention, through the elimination of the unfit. “At no stage has there been any transfusion of knowledge from the outside, not of mechanisms of knowing, nor of fundamental certainties.” (Campbell, 1974: 413). Therefore, according to Campbell (1960: 380-381):

All knowledge-gaining-processes or inductive achievements are the result of a blind-variation-and-selective-retention scheme. The latter is thus a universal schema or heuristic that can account for the evolution of these different processes.
Furthermore, within the course of evolution, one can distinguish between many later-evolved processes that shortcut full blind-variation-and-selective-retention processes. Vision, for example, shortcuts blind trial and error locomotion. Such new mechanisms are also inductively achieved (by natural selection). The process by which these inductively achieved mechanisms shortcut and accelerate earlier mechanisms is called vicarious selection. This concept is derived from the Christian vicar, because such shortcuts substitute earlier mechanisms in a way that a vicar substitutes God. What is important is that knowledge mechanisms that are acquired later are (again because they are inductively achieved) not necessarily more accurate; they are only more efficient (Campbell, 1959: 162). These shortcuts themselves evolved through a process of blind-variation-and-selective-retention. And later stages partly determine earlier stages of knowledge processes which Campbell (1974) termed downward causation.
Finally, these shortcuts have not only evolved by blind-variation-and-selective-retention. In the operation of these shortcuts, a blind-variation-and-selective-retention process can also be detected. Thus it is Campbell who is the first to state clearly that not only does a selection process lie at the basis of evolution, but also that this selection process itself adheres to such a selection process.

In his 1995 article (published posthumously in 1997 by Heyes and Frankel), Campbell rejected his earlier ideas about treating adaptations as knowledge and he restricted knowledge to be those vicarious selectors. In fact, the whole adaptationist approach became more and more problematic to Campbell (1987: 140) in his later writings and he started to emphasize that Panglossian adaptationism needs to be avoided at all times within EE. Retention is equally important, just as variation and selection are, especially when science is concerned.

iv. Stephen Toulmin

Specifically regarding scientific thinking, especially in the works of Stephen Toulmin (1972), a strong analogy is drawn with natural selection. Ideas and concepts are the results of scientific thinking and these are, by analogy with the gene pool, introduced into the pool of scientists through science journals, conferences, books etc., leading to the rise of competition between different ideas. Only the fittest ideas survive while the less fit die out. However, this “fitness” is not solely the result of the scientific value of the idea; other factors enter into the equation. For example, sociological reasons are included as causal factors for why an idea is or is not rejected.

v. Peter Munz

Peter Munz, another author working within the adaptationist program, calls his version of EE, “Philosophical Darwinism” (2001). Contrary to the previous authors discussed, Munz states that even variation, which is normally conceived of as being blind (the result of random mutations and genetic recombinations), is the result of a selective process. Inspired by the works of Popper, he goes so far as to state that organisms are “embodied theories,” and theories are “disembodied organisms.”

According to Munz (2001: 151-160), every organism is a theory about its environment. That is, an organism primarily gives knowledge about the environment. Moreover, an organism can be regarded as a definition of that environment. An organism mirrors its environment because of selective adaptation. Therefore, an organism literally becomes a not yet falsified theory of a certain aspect of the environment, its Umwelt/niche, and thus it becomes a provisionally true hypothesis. A theory/organism — the two are synonymous in Munz’s view — has certain expectancies about its environment, and if these are met, then the organism/theory survives; if not, the organism/theory is falsified. The longer an organism/theory survives, the more truth is approximated.

The behavior of a fish and the functioning of a theory of water are exactly identical. The fish represents water by its structure and its functioning. Both features define an initial condition (for example, the degree of viscosity of water) which, when spotted or sensed, trigger off a prognosis or behavioral response which, in case of a fish, fails to be falsified. By contrast, a bird does not represent water (Munz, 2001: 155) .

Thus, an organism is an embodied theory about its environment. An organism re-presents that part of the world that it is adapted to and this representation is thus no longer verbal or conscious. Embodied theories, according to Munz, are also no longer expressed in language, but in anatomical structures or reflex responses, etc.

Besides regarding organisms as embodied theories, theories become disembodied organisms in Munz’s view. A human being is both because it possesses linguistic knowledge. Linguistically expressed theories, according to Munz (2001: 160-8), are also the result of a process of variation and selective retention. Here too, linguistically expressed theories are literally organisms. In the wake of Popper, Munz stresses that theories should be reified. Linguistic theories are built up from language, and there exists no causal link between this language and the causal impact that the world has upon the non-linguistic body. Therefore, language and consciousness create uncertainty: expressions can only be hypothetical. In addition, at first language appears to be maladaptive, since it delays non-linguistic, embodied responses. Nevertheless, such expressions are adaptive as well, because they enable variation. Selection can only work when there is variation which it can select from, and therefore, for Munz, the growth of scientific linguistic knowledge is possible.

In contrast to previous adaptationist EEs, according to Munz, this variation is also the result of selectionist processes. Eventually, Munz (2001: 184) stresses that his theory results in an antropic principle. With the origin and evolution of life, the world represents itself, onto itself, through disembodied organisms and embodied theories. Contrary to physics, it is biology that can give us a valid picture of how the world is.

In summary, within traditional evolutionary epistemological accounts, the strict distinction between phenotype and environment, as put forward by adherents of the Modern Synthesis, is adhered to. This leads to the possibility that one can gain knowledge about the environment by studying organisms that are adaptive to that environment. Thus, within this tradition it is assumed that organisms can provide a non-arbitrary relation, not between language and the outer world, but between whole organisms (their bodies) and the outer world. This position however encounters problems when one takes an organismic point of view, a position that will be discussed in the next section.

6. Evolution from the Point of View of the Organism

When evolution is regarded from within an organismic point of view, a constructivist account emerges which in turn leads to the non-adaptationist approach within EE. Therefore, first the constructivist approach is examined. Secondly, the elements that are subtracted from this approach for the development of the non-adaptationist approach to EE are outlined.

a. The Constructivist Approach

Following Lewontin and Gould’s critical review of the adaptationist program, evolutionary theory was interrogated from less adaptationist perspectives as well. Opposed to the strict adaptationist account, the systems theoretical approach defends the following constructivist position.

…[T]he claim that the environment of an organism is causally independent of the organism, and the changes in the environment are autonomous and independent of changes in the species itself, is clearly wrong. It is bad biology, and every ecologist and evolutionary biologist knows that it is bad biology. The metaphor of adaptation, while once an important heuristic for building evolutionary theory, is now an impediment to a real understanding of the evolutionary process that needs to be replaced by another. Although all metaphors are dangerous, the actual process of evolution seems best captured by the process of construction. (Lewontin: 2000: 48)

Instead of portraying organisms as passive elements that are subjected to selection, Lewontin (2000: 51-64) introduces a more constructivist approach to evolution in which five different aspects of the organism-environment relation are distinguishable.

Organisms partly determine by themselves which elements from the external environment belong to their environment or niche, and they determine to a large extent how these different elements relate to one another. A shrub, for example, can be part of the habitat of a butterfly, while a tree is not.
Organisms not only largely choose what is part of their environment; they also literally construe the environment that surrounds them. This process is called niche construction. Beavers, for example, build their own dams.
Furthermore, organisms constantly change their environment in an active manner; every act of consumption is an act of production. The first photosynthetic organisms, for example, changed earth dramatically from an oxygen-low to an oxygen-rich planet.
Through time, organisms learn to anticipate the external conditions that the environment provides. For instance, according to certain environmental conditions, certain chordates are able to switch from a sexual to an asexual form. Other organisms hoard food for the winter.
Finally, according to Lewontin, organisms modify signals that are coming from their surrounding by their biological build-up. That is to say, they modify external signals into internal signals to which their bodies are able to react. For example, if the external temperature rises, the molecules that form the organisms do not start to tremble. Rather, an internal signal in the brain will lead to the release of certain hormones that cool the body down so that it does not get overheated.

Hence, from within the systems theoretical approach, the relation between an organism and its environment is understood from within a dialectical point of view (Callebaut & Pinxten, 1987: 41, Gontier, 2006).

ev-ep-diagram2

Figure 2. Within systems theory, the focus lies not only on the mutual relation between the organism and
its environment, rather internal processes specific to the organism and/or the environment are taken into account.

An organism not only is determined by the external environment, the organism can also, to a certain extent, determine its environment by construing and reconstruing it in an active manner (fig. 2). Therefore, the concept “environment” is also broadened to include the inner environment where inner homeostatic, self-regulating processes are responsible for an organism’s survival (point 4 and 5 above). Because of this, it is said that the constructivist approach explains evolution from the organismic point of view (Gutmann and Weingarten 1990; Wuketits, 2006).

b. The Non-Adaptationist Approach within EE

The non-adaptationist approach to EE was first introduced by Franz Wuketits (1989). All adaptationist approaches to EE adhere to the view that it is possible, to an extent, to develop a correspondence theory. A correspondence theory states that there is a 1-to-1 correspondence between the environment and the organisms that live in it, or between theories and the world. For instance, the ant can tell us something about the soil. In order to make this claim feasible, natural selection needs to be reduced to, or at a minimum the emphasis should rest heavily on, the mechanism of adaptation. It is only through the mechanism of adaptation that such correspondence can be obtained.

In the wake of Ludwig von Bertalanffy, one of the founders of systems theory, the importance of the study of the whole organism is stressed, next to the study of the (adaptive) relation between the organism and the environment. Within systems theory, organisms are conceived of as partly open, partly closed systems. That is to say, organisms constantly take matter and energy from, and give matter and energy to, their environment, while they themselves maintain a “steady state” (Wuketits, 2002: 193). Later on, Prigogine (1996) would introduce the concept of “dissipative structures.” A whirlpool, for example, maintains its form while the water of which it is composed, constantly changes. But once the water flow stops, the whirlpool no longer exists. Organisms are more than such dissipative structures. They are homeostatic systems, because not only can they self-regulate and self-organize, they can also maintain themselves to a certain extent. That is why it is said that organisms are partly open, partly closed systems; they receive and donate matter and energy to and from their environment. They also distinguish themselves from that environment and are able to construct their environment as well.

Developmental systems theory (DST) (Maturana and Varela 1980; Oyama 2000a and b; Dupré 2001) grew out of systems theory and, as the concept suggests, it focuses on developmental processes. It understands organisms to be autocatalytic systems, systems which are able to self-organize and self-maintain, not so much because they are adapted to the environment they live in, but because they are able to self-maintain, sometimes even despite the environment, due to the inner mechanisms they develop in order to survive. Therefore, these inner mechanisms of self-organization and self-regulation are comprehended as causal factors that need to be part of the explanation of why organisms behave in a certain manner.

Within the non-adaptationist tradition of EE, being adapted does not mean that there is a one-to-one correspondence with the environment. Instead, being adapted implies having the ability to change the environment to make it livable for the organism, and thus to enhance survival. Adaptation thus becomes only one aspect that needs to be studied, together with non-adaptationist approaches. Wuketits (2006: 38-9):

… a nonadaptationist view of cognition and knowledge and a nonadaptationist version of evolutionary epistemology (…) is mainly based on the following assumptions: (1) Cognition is the function of active bio-systems and not of blind machines that just respond to the outer world. (2) Cognition is not a reaction to the outer world but results from complex interactions between the organism and its surroundings. (3) Cognition is not a linear process of step-by-step accumulation of information but a complex process of continuous error elimination.

In sum, an EE based upon systems theoretical evolutionary theory is not anti-adaptationist (Wuketits 1995: 359-60). It is non-adaptationist because the world constantly changes because of the organisms that inhabit it. This makes it difficult to approximate a one-to-one correspondence.

Instead of adhering to such a correspondence theory, the non-adaptationist approach puts forward a coherence theory. Because of these processes of inner self-organization, self-regulation and the possibility for an organism to partially (re)construct its environment, an organism is partly capable of creating its own habitat. Different organisms develop different habitats because they have evolved differently and have different inner mechanisms which enable them to cope with, and interact with, the outer world. Here, according to Wuketits (2006), it is not useful to ask which habitat is more real or more in correspondence with the world in itself (an sich), because every organism capable of surviving has proven that it is adequate. Therefore a coherence theory adheres to a functional notion of reality. What an organism, according to its own inner mechanisms of perception, perceives as real, is real for that organism in its struggle for existence. If that organism is able to survive because of the way it perceives things, it is able to reproduce and reintroduce its genes into the gene pool. Wuketits (2006: 43):

First, organisms do not simply get a picture of (parts of) reality, but develop, as was already hinted at, a particular scheme of reaction. … Second, the notion of a world-in-itself becomes obsolete or at least redundant. What counts for any organism is that it copes with its own world properly.

7. Evolution from the Point of View of Genes

Thus far we have examined the “organismic point of view” towards evolution defended by the systems theoretical approach, and the description of evolution from the “point of view of the environment” as is the case with the Modern Synthesis. A third and final alternative for describing evolution is the “gene’s eye view.” The gene’s eye view was introduced by Richard Dawkins (1976), following Williams (1966).

This approach opened the discussion concerning universal Darwinism (section 7) and introduced the important concept of a “replicator,” a concept that is often used within universal selectionism.

According to Dawkins (1982: 162) the unit of selection is not the phenotype, but the replicator: “… any entity in the universe of which copies are made” and this replicator, contrary to the vehicles that temporarily house them “…is potentially immortal… the rationale is that an entity must have a low rate of spontaneous, endogenous change, if the selective advantage of its phenotypic effects over those of rival (‘allelic’) entities is to have any significant effect.” (Dawkins, 1982: 164).

A replicator carries information that can be copied. An example par excellence is genetic material that, according to the specific sequence of nucleotides (the building blocks of genes), encodes for certain characteristics. Organisms, according to Dawkins, are mere vehicles that temporarily accommodate such information-carrying replicators. In the long run, because of their longevity, fecundity and copying-fidelity, these “selfish genes” outlive their temporary housing. Therefore, the emphasis for Dawkins should lie on the replicator, not the individual organism. That is not to say that the environmental approach so characteristic of the Modern Synthesis is wrong, according to Dawkins, rather it should be complemented with the gene’s point of view of evolution.

…[t]here are two ways in which we can characterize natural selection. Both are correct: they simply focus on different aspects of the same process. Evolution results from the differential survival of replicators. Genes are replicators; organisms and groups of organisms are not replicators, they are vehicles in which replicators travel about. Vehicle selection is the process by which some vehicles are more successful than other vehicles in ensuring the survival of their replicators. (Dawkins, 1982: 162)

It is the organism’s job to deliver its genes as quickly and faithfully as possible within the gene pool. “Vehicle selection is the differential success of vehicles in propagating the replicators that ride inside them.” (Dawkins, 1982: 166) Every behavior an organism displays that is not reducible to the benefit of its genetic material is, from the point of view of the gene, futile and even unnecessarily costly. Organisms are only important in so far as they are able to propagate their genes. Therefore, although this view can be complemented with the Modern Synthesis, it stands opposed to the “organismic point of view.”

8. Universal Selection Mechanisms Repeated and Extended

Thus far we have seen that the units and levels of selection debate that started within biology also set off an evolutionary epistemological debate concerning the different units and levels of selection in science.

One of the main goals set forward by many Evolutionary Epistemologists is the development of a normative and explanatory framework that is based upon, and is at the least analogical to, evolutionary thinking. The quest for universal selection formulas that was already launched as early as the nineteenth century was spurred again by this units and levels of selection debate. The goal of such a uniform universal formula is that it not only explains biological evolution, but also the evolution of science, culture, the brain, economics, etc.

Scientists and philosophers alike have introduced different formulas that generalize and universalize natural selection and other evolutionary theories. Discussions in the field revolve around the question of whether there exists one universal selection formula which can be utilized to interpret all other kinds of evolutionary processes (including the evolution of culture, psychology, immunology, language, etc.), or whether such formulas can only help at a descriptive, and therefore, merely analogical, level. In what follows, different evolutionary frameworks are briefly touched upon so that the interested reader has an idea of where to look for different applications of these schemas.

a. Lewontin’s “Logical Skeleton” of Natural Selection

Lewontin (1970: 1) was the first to make an abstraction of natural selection. He argued that “the logical skeleton” of Darwin’s theory is “a powerful predictive system for changes at all levels of biological organization.” Lewontin distinguishes between three principles: phenotypic variation, differential fitness (because of different environments) and the heritability of that fitness. Lewontin (1970: 1) introduced this logical skeleton to pinpoint “different units of Mendelian, cytoplasmic, or cultural inheritance.” He distinguished between the selection of molecules (regarding the origin of life), cell organelles (regarding cytoplasmic evolution), cellular selection (different cell types divide at different rates, comparable with what today is called epigenetics), gametic selection, individual selection, kin selection and population selection.

b. Universal Darwinism

Dawkins (1983: 15) states that wherever life originates, that life can only be explained by using Darwin’s theory of natural selection. According to Dawkins, the most important property of life is that it is adapted to its environment, and adaptation requires a Darwinist explanation. Dawkins (1983: 16) states: “I agree with Maynard Smith […] that ‘The main task of evolution is to explain complexity, that is, to explain the same set of facts which Paley used as evidence of a Creator.’”

Organisms are “adaptively complex” (Dawkins, 1983: 17). This means that a complex structure like the eye, for example, evolved by natural selection for vision. Organisms or organismal traits are adapted to the environment and also evolved to enable adaptation towards that environment. Thus, through adaptation, an organism possesses information about that environment (Dawkins, 1983: 21). Selection refers to “…the non-random selection of randomly varying replicating entities by reason of their ‘phenotypic’ effects” (Dawkins, 1983: 32). It can be further divided into “one-off selection” and “cumulative selection.” The former relates to the selection of a stable configuration, a universally occurring process. The latter enables complex adaptation, because the next generation builds upon earlier generations through such things as the passing on of genes, but not solely by this mechanism.

Most importantly, for Dawkins, it is replicators that are selected. The reason that he introduces the concept “replicator” is twofold. First, he wants to extend the Modern Synthesis by introducing the gene’s eye view. Second, he introduces the term replicator, instead of gene, because he wants to universalize the principle of natural selection. The unit of selection, according to Dawkins, is the replicator, but replicator is a generic term; not only genes (individual genes or whole chunks of the chromosome), but also memes –which he defines as “… brain structures whose ‘phenotypic’ manifestation as behavior or artifact is the basis of their [cultural] selection,” are replicators (Dawkins, 1982: 164). The idea of memetics was later expanded by Blackmore (1999).

c. Blind Variation and Selective Retention

Campbell’s scheme is a formula that can be universalized. Every relationship that an organism engages in with its environment is a knowledge relation. Variation is blind, either because of random mutations and genetic recombinations, or, in the case of the development of scientific theories, blind trials result in blind variation.

Selection does not only occur at the level of the interaction between phenotype and environment, for selection is also internalized by the process of vicarious selection (see above). And trial and error learning has always been somewhat synonymous with blind-variation-and-selective-retention, according to Campbell.

In his earlier writings, Campbell (1959, 1960) emphasizes the notion of variation, because only when there is sufficient variation will there be competition and selection. Later, he emphasized the selective retention-part of his theory: those traits that are already adaptive also need to be retained by the current generation in order to keep being adaptive. In science as well, existing theories must be retained and passed on to the next generation through learning, or this information dies out. Hence tradition within culture or science, for example, also became a more important element in Campbell’s later writings (1987).

d. Universal Selectionism

The concept “universal selectionism” was first introduced by Gary Cziko (1995) and roughly corresponds with Campbell’s blind-variation-and-selective-retention scheme, although he prefers the term selectionism. In his 1995 book, Cziko explains this scheme as being applicable not only to biological evolution, but also to the evolution and growth of knowledge, immunology, and the development of the brain, thinking and culture. Selectionism is the only theory that, according to Cziko (1995: 13- 26), can explain the fit of an organism with its environment. Throughout history, providentialism and instructionism have also been assumed to explain this fit, but only selectionism can explain the mechanism of adaptation.

e. Replication, Variation and Environmental Interaction

The replication, variation, and environmental interaction scheme was first introduced by David Hull (1980) as a critique on Dawkins’s notion of replicators and vehicles. In Dawkins’s view, organisms are mere vehicles that temporarily accommodate the selfish genes that ride inside them and an organism can actually be equated with the workings of its genes. Hull’s theory differs from Dawkins’s, because the former states that organisms can display behavior that is not reducible to their genes. On a more general level, Hull introduced the notion of an interactor to complement Dawkins’s view (1980). Thus, he basically re-introduced the common assumption held by the Modern Synthesis that what interacts with the environment are organisms, not genes. But the notion of interaction can also be universalized. The most recent account of this formula is given in Hull, Langman and Glenn (2001).

For selection to occur, three conditions need to be met: replication, variation, and environmental interaction. Replication is dependent on the interaction between the organism and its environment (Hull, Langman and Glenn, 2001: 511). The formula they propose should be equally applicable to biology, immunology and operant behavior, although it should not be identical to biological selection theory. All three sorts of evolution share certain properties but also have their own peculiarities. Changes in operant behavior, for example, are not transmitted immediately to the next generation.

In contrast to Campbell and Plotkin, Hull, Langman, and Glenn (2001: 513) define selection as “[The] repeated cycles of replication, variation, and environmental interaction so structured that environmental interaction causes replication to be differential. The net effect is the evolution of the lineages produced by this process.”

Within postneodarwinian theory, variation is either perceived as part of the selection process, or as a precondition for selection to occur. If variation occurs, this results either from mutations that occur in the sex cells at the biological level, or from different behavioral patterns that in their own right are the result of environmental interaction. Replication, according to these authors (Hull, Langman and Glenn, 2001: 514-6), concerns the repetition/copying of “information.”

Finally, environmental interaction is characterized as causing replication to differ because certain replicators are more frequently selected than others, which in turn has nothing to do with the introduction of new variation. Only at the level of interaction between the organism and the environment does selection occur.

Hull’s scheme is one of the few schemes that has already been implemented in extra-philosophical and extra-biological fields. William Croft (2000, 2002) for instance uses it for the study of language change.

f. Generate-Test-Regenerate / Replicator-Interactor-Lineage

Plotkin prefers the notion of “universal Darwinism” over universal selectionism (1995, chapter 3). He distinguishes between two universal formulas. The first, the generate-test/selection-regenerate formula is more general. It does not a priori say anything about the mechanisms or units that cause this generating and testing. This formula is again very close to Campbell’s scheme. as well as Lewontin’s (Plotkin, 1995: 84). A second formula does specify the units and mechanisms: replication, interaction and lineages. The reason Plotkin distinguishes between the two is that he wants to avoid having to pinpoint a priori a replicator in cultural evolution.

Selection processes, according to Plotkin, always take place in three steps: first, there is the generation of variation, and the nature of variation does not in itself need to be specified (genes, phenotypes, theories etc. all can vary). This phase is always followed by a test phase, where natural selection is of course the prototypical way in which there occurs selection based upon the test results. Finally, there is regeneration of old and newly evolved varieties (Plotkin, 1995: 84). While it is obvious that Plotkin mainly has the selection of genetic material in mind here, he also sees his formula appropriate in order to explain learning and intelligence. How information is transmitted is not determined a priori, rather it is important that old variations are regenerated throughout time.

The replicator-interactor-lineage formula is first an elaboration and specialization of Plotkin’s first formula since it combines Dawkins’s notion of a replicator with Hull’s notions of an interactor and lineage, the latter term referring to “… entities that can change indefinitely through time as a result of replication and interaction.” (Plotkin, 1995: 97). Hull himself defines lineages as “… spatiotemporal sequences of entities that causally produce one another. Entities in the sequence are in some sense ‘descended’ from those earlier in the sequence” (1981: 146).

According to Plotkin (1995: xv), adaptation and knowledge are related in two ways: first the capacity to acquire knowledge is in itself an adaptation, and secondly, adaptations are also a form of knowledge. Adaptations are “in-formed” by the environment. Therefore, adaptation is knowledge (Plotkin, 1995: 116) and there can be a tentative growth of knowledge.

g. Universal Symbiogenesis

SET, the Serial Endo-symbiogenetic Theory of Lynn Margulis and Dorian Sagan (2002), is a theory that describes the origin of the five kingdoms. In brief, different bacteria merged and evolved into multi-cellular life. What is interesting here is that different bacteria literally merged and thus that evolution does not exclusively occur according to speciation models. The physicist Freeman Dyson (1992) therefore introduces the principle of universal symbiogenesis, where symbiotic mergings and speciation models intertwine. Throughout the evolution of life, which is the same for the evolution of the universe, there is an increase in diversification on the one hand and symbiogenesis on the other. Different structures originate and then later merge to form new structures. Within the evolution of life, there was the origin of the first microbial organisms, which than merged again and evolved into multi-cellular organisms.

Dyson defines universal symbiogenesis as “the reattachment of two structures, after they have been detached from each other and have evolved along separate paths for a long time, so as to form a combined structure with behavior not seen in the separate components” (Dyson, 1998: 121).

In conclusion, it can be said that the specific theory of evolution that one adheres to also partly determines what kind of evolutionary epistemology can be adhered to. Since evolutionary epistemology bases itself first on the sciences, no attempt is made by different evolutionary epistemologists to put forward one all-encompassing theory or program that all evolutionary epistemologists should adhere too. On the contrary, the diversity of evolutionary epistemologies is championed by scholars working in the field.

9. References and Further Reading

Ayala, Francisco J. 1978. “The Mechanisms of Evolution.” Scientific American 239 (3): 48-61.
Blackmore, Susan. 1999. The Meme Machine – with a foreword of Richard Dawkins. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Bradie, Michael, 1986. “Assessing Evolutionary Epistemology.” Biology & Philosophy, 1, 401-459.
Brandon, Robert N. 1982. “The Levels of Selection.” In: Brandon, Robert N.; and Burian, Richard M. (eds). 1984. Genes, Organisms, Populations: Controversies over the units of selection 133-9. Cambridge: Massachusetts Institute of Technology.
Brandon, Robert N.; and Burian, Richard M. (eds). 1984. Genes, Organisms, Populations: Controversies over the Units of Selection. Cambridge: Massachusetts Institute of Technology.
Callebaut, Werner; and Pinxten, Rik. 1987. “Evolutionary Epistemology Today: Converging Views from Philosophy, the Natural and Social Sciences.” In: Callebaut, Werner; and Pinxten, Rik, (eds.). 1987. Evolutionary Epistemology: A Multiparadigm Program With a Complete Evolutionary Epistemology Bibliography 3-55. Dordrecht: Reidel.
Callebaut, Werner. 1993. Taking The Naturalistic Turn or How Real Philosophy of Science Is Done. Chicago IL: The University of Chicago Press.
Campbell, Donald T. 1959. “Methodological Suggestions from a Comparative Psychology of Knowledge Processes.” Inquiry 2 (3): 152-83.
Campbell, Donald T. 1960. “Blind Variation and Selective Retention in Creative Thought as in Other Knowledge Processes.” Psychological Review 67(6): 380-400.
Campbell, Donald T. 1974. “Evolutionary Epistemology.” In: Schlipp, Paul A. (ed.), The Philosophy of Karl Popper Vol. I, 413-459. Illinois: La Salle.
Campbell, Donald T. 1987. “Selection Theory and the Sociology of Scientific Validity.” In: Callebaut, Werner; and Pinxten, Rik (eds), Evolutionary Epistemology 139-58. Dordrecht: D. Reidel Publishing Company.
Campbell, Donald T. 1997. “From Evolutionary Epistemology Via Selection Theory to a Sociology of Scientific Validity: Edited by Cecilia Heyes and Barbara Frankel” Evolution and Cognition, 3 (1), 5-38.
Changeaux, Jean-Pierre. 1985. Neuronal Man: The Biology of Mind. New York: Oxford University Press.
Croft, William. 2000. Explaining Language Change: An Evolutionary Approach. Essex: Pearson.
Croft, William. 2002. “The Darwinization of Linguistics.” Selection 3(1): 75-91.
Cziko, Gary. 1995. Without Miracles: Universal Selection Theory and the Second Darwinian Revolution. Cambridge: Massachusetts Institute of Technology.
Damasio, Antonio R. 1996 (1994). Descartes’s Error: Emotion, Reason and the Human Brain. London: Papermac [First published by New York: Grosset/Putnam].Damasio, Antonio R. 1999. The Feeling of What Happens: Body and Emotion in the Making of Consciousness. New York: Harcourt Brace & Company.
Dawkins, Richard. 1976. The Selfish Gene. New York: Oxford University Press.
Dawkins, Richard. 1983. “Universal Darwinism.” In: Hull, David Lee; and Ruse, Michael (eds), The Philosophy of Biology 15-35. Oxford: Oxford University Press [First published in: Bendall, D. S. (ed.), 1998. Evolution from Molecules to Man 403-25. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press].
Dawkins, Richard. 1982. “Replicators and Vehicles.” In: Brandon, N. R.; and Burian, R. M. (eds) 1984, Genes, Organisms, Populations 161-79. Cambridge: Massachusetts Institute of Technology Press.
Dupré, John. 2001. Human Nature and the Limits of Science. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
Dyson, Freeman. 1998. “The Evolution of Science.” In: Fabian, Andrew C. (ed.), Evolution: Society, Science and the Universe 118-35. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
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Research for this article was supported by the Fund for Scientific Research – Flanders (F.W.O.-Vlaanderen) and the Centre for Logic and Philosophy of Science, where the author is a Research Assistant.

Author Information

Nathalie Gontier
Email: Nathalie.Gontier@vub.ac.be
Vrije Universiteit Brussel
Belgium

Cicero: Academic Skepticism

cicero-02 Cicero (106 to 43 B.C.E.) adopted the philosophical view of the Academic skeptics as a young man sometime in the 80’s. In 89/8, Philo of Larissa, the head of Plato’s Academy, fled from Athens to Rome for political reasons. While at Rome, Cicero attended Philo’s public lectures and began to study philosophy with him. Cicero also studied with the most prominent representatives of other Hellenistic philosophical schools: Posidonius (a Stoic), Zeno of Citium and Phaedrus (Epicureans), and Cratippus (a Peripatetic). Although the Academy probably ceased to exist as an institution after Philo’s death in 84, Cicero continued to champion its methodology in his philosophical dialogues.

The Academic position appealed to Cicero for a variety of reasons (Section 1). The Academics argued on both sides of every issue in order to undermine the dogmatic confidence of their interlocutors. Cicero’s teacher Philo also applied this method in order to determine which position enjoyed the most rational support. Given his rhetorical and forensic skills, Cicero likely found this method attractive. It was also ideal for his project of inducing the ruling class Romans to take up the practice of philosophy. Rather than present his personal views, Cicero laid out in dialogue form the strongest arguments he could mine from other philosophical texts. The idea was to encourage the reader to come to his own conclusion, but even more importantly, to adopt the Academic method of inquiry. Perhaps the most attractive feature of Academic philosophy for Cicero was the intellectual freedom guaranteed by the method. The Academic is bound to no particular doctrine as an Academic. He is only bound to accept the verdict of his best rational assessment of the arguments pro and con.

Cicero asserts that the reasons for his Academic allegiance are set out fully in his Academica (De Natura Deorum 1.11). Although these Academic books are fragmentary, they nonetheless provide a detailed account of the dispute between the Academics and Stoics on the possibility of knowledge (Sections 2 and 3) along with Philo’s explanation for how we can manage quite well without knowledge (Section 4).

The Skeptical Academy and its Appeal to Cicero
Arguments For and Against Stoic Epistemology in the Academica
Indirect Arguments in Support of Stoic Epistemology in the Academica
The Positive Fallibilism of the Philonian Academy
References and Further Reading
1. Latin Texts and Translations
2. Select Bibliography of Secondary Literature

1. The Skeptical Academy and its Appeal to Cicero

There were some important variations among the Academics during the Academy’s skeptical period (c. 268/7 B.C.E to 1st century B.C.E.), but there is also a unifying feature. They all focused squarely, if not exclusively, on refutation. Inspired by Socrates (as he appears in some of Plato’s dialogues), they sought to combat the overly confident attitude of the dogmatists. Since the Stoics were the most influential dogmatists of the time, the skeptical Academics devoted much of their energy to combating them in particular. (Dogmatism in the Hellenistic period is simply a matter of positively affirming that one knows the truth of some systematically related philosophical propositions—it need not have the pejorative connotation currently associated with it.)

In order to refute their opponents, the Academics argued dialectically. Rather than assert a position themselves, they would reveal to the interlocutor that his beliefs are mutually inconsistent and thus that he is not able to justify his claim to knowledge. For example, suppose I claim to know that justice is whatever the strong say it is. Then, in response to a skeptic’s questioning, I am led on the basis of my own premises to conclude that justice is not whatever the strong say it is. It follows that I did not really know what I claimed to know. The operative assumption is that if I had known what justice is, I would have been able to show why my belief is true. If I contradict myself or run out of plausible reasons, then I do not know what justice is after all—even if my belief turns out to be true, I do not know why it is true.

Later Academics also began arguing on both sides of every issue, pro and con. Some apparently sought to show that nothing whatsoever could be known about the issue in question. To accomplish this end, they showed others that there are equally strong arguments for and against, and thus no compelling reason to accept any position. Others employed the same method in order to discover which side of an issue could be most plausibly defended. But all of the Academics agreed that the Stoics had failed to adequately defend their epistemology; that is, they had not shown that knowledge is possible (much more on this below in sections 2 and 3).

Cicero found the later Academic position appealing for a variety of reasons. The method of arguing pro and con was a natural fit with his tremendous oratorical and forensic skill. As a lawyer and orator he was pleased by the Academy’s insistence on teaching rhetoric along with philosophy on the grounds that the two disciplines were mutually supportive. He also found the position ideally suited to his philosophical project of inspiring the Roman ruling class to take up the practice of philosophy. In his dialogues he employs the Academic method with the intention of encouraging his readers to think for themselves rather than to rely on authority.

He was perhaps most attracted by the Academics’ intellectual freedom. In his earliest statement of Academic allegiance, Cicero remarks that he will gladly change his opinion if someone points out his error. For it is not shameful to have insufficiently understood something. It is shameful, however, to have persevered foolishly and for a long time with insufficient understanding. The reason for this is that insufficient understanding is due to the common weakness of mankind. It is, to some extent inevitable, or at least excusable. Foolish perseverance, however, can be avoided, and hence is shameful and blameworthy. (De Inventione 2.9) Cicero describes such perseverance as the stubborn adherence to one’s position because he has come to feel some affection for it. The Academic, by contrast, is supposed to have no extra-rational motives in defending his view or in persevering, when or if he does.

Part of the rationale for this way of proceeding is that we cannot fully appreciate the relative strengths and weaknesses of the available philosophical positions unless we have thoroughly explored what can be said for and against them. To align oneself to a philosophical position prior to this is premature. As we start out we lack the knowledge or wisdom we seek, and thus we are not in a position to adequately judge which system or which philosopher to follow. Once one undertakes the Academic project, he or she may find, as Cicero did, that one lifetime is not sufficient for completing the project and taking a final stand.

This freedom to change one’s position in accordance with a new assessment of the arguments may appear to dispense with any concern for consistency. Suppose for example that I no longer believe that the arguments in favor of going to war with Carthage are compelling. While I previously believed Rome was justified in going to war, I now believe the opposite. As an Academic I am free to change my position as often as I like. I am not bound by any doctrinal constraints due to my philosophical allegiance. And I am not bound by what I formerly believed. Remaining consistent with my former beliefs is never as important as accepting the verdict of my current assessment of the arguments.

Academic freedom is not an end in itself however; it is a means to arriving at the most rationally defensible position. This is why Cicero characterizes the Academic’s method as aimed at drawing out and articulating that view which can be maintained most consistently (Academica 2.9) and as aimed at revealing what is true or at least the closest approximation to the truth (Academica 2.7, 2.65-66, De Officiis 2.8, Tusculan Disputations 1.8). The consistency sought is an accord with the rational evidence and not with one’s previous beliefs.

Cicero frequently singles out this freedom as the most definitive and attractive feature of the Academics’ philosophical practice (for example, De Legibus 1.36, Academica 2.134, Tusculan Disputations 4.83, 5.33, 5.82, De Officiis 2.7, 3.20). They alone are free to accept whatever strikes them as most plausible at that moment (see Section 4 below for more on Academic probabilism).

2. Arguments For and Against Stoic Epistemology in the Academica

During his final encyclopedic burst of dialogues (46-44 B.C.), Cicero wrote his epistemological work, the Academica. The original version contained two books named after the principal interlocutor in each, Catulus and Lucullus. The latter of the two is extant, and generally referred to as Ac. 2 or Lucullus (= Luc.). Cicero revised these original two books, dividing them into four, and replaced Lucullus with Varro as principal interlocutor throughout. Only about the first fourth of the revised version is extant. It is generally referred to as Ac. 1.

In these books Cicero presents arguments for and against the Stoic theory of knowledge as well as the Academics’ own positive, fallibilistic alternative. It should be noted that ethics and epistemology are inextricably connected in the Academic books. Cicero remarks on several occasions that what they are investigating is the sage—that is, an ideal of the perfectly wise human being. Ultimately, the question about the possibility of knowledge on the Stoic account, and in Hellenistic philosophy in general, is a question about the possibility of wisdom. The Hellenistic philosophers followed Plato’s Socrates in taking their primary task to be the discovery of the best human life.

In order to meet this challenge, Zeno of Citium, the founder of Stoicism, developed an account of how the knowledge that Socrates sought—that is, the knowledge that guides one in living the best possible human life—could in fact be attained. That it could be attained he established on the grounds that the universe is providentially arranged. From the providential arrangement it follows that human beings must be equipped to satisfy their desire for knowledge, for Nature would not have acted so capriciously as to give us such an important desire without also providing the means to fulfill it.

If one developed his natural abilities in accordance with Nature he would eventually learn to infallibly distinguish what is true from what is false, at least with regard to matters pertaining to happiness. The sage is not omniscient, but he is infallible. His knowledge guarantees that he will always live in accordance with nature, which is identical to being virtuous and happy.

All of the sage’s beliefs are true, and grasped in such a way that no experience and no argument is able to dislodge him from his conviction. This irrefutability depends crucially on the fact that all of the sage’s beliefs are true and firmly grasped as such. If he were to hold even one false belief he might be persuaded to rely on it in abandoning true beliefs. So we can see that the sage’s knowledge is systematic in that each of his true beliefs is supported by the others.

The foundation of this account of knowledge is a type of impression about which we cannot be mistaken. This type of impression provides us with a criterion of truth, that is, a measuring stick one can use to determine what is and what is not the case. If the Academics could succeed in showing that there are no such impressions, they would effectively undermine the possibility of attaining the knowledge built upon them.

Thus, the central issue in Ac. 2 is whether or not an impression can be apprehended or grasped in such a way as to guarantee its truth. Zeno described such an impression as cognitive, or mentally graspable (katalêpton), and defined it as one that

(1) comes from what is the case, that is, some existent state of affairs
(2) accurately conveys all the relevant features of what it comes from, and
(3) cannot be exactly like an impression that comes from what is not the case (Ac. 2.77, cp. Sextus’ account at Adversus Mathematikos [= M] 7.248).

Katalêpsis occurs when one assents to a cognitive impression, thereby firmly grasping its truth. So whenever one assents to a cognitive impression one necessarily forms a true belief.

The pressing question is whether one can learn to distinguish cognitive from non-cognitive impressions. It seems that one can never know whether (1) and (2) have been satisfied except by inspecting the perceptual content of the impression. If so, this opens the way for the Academics’ main objection. (It should be noted that the Stoics did not think all cognitive impressions are perceptual. We may have cognitive impressions of evaluative states of affairs—for example that it is good for us to help our friend. However most of the evidence regarding the possibility of such impressions is limited to perceptual cases, and so the following discussion will be similarly limited.)

The Academics demanded that the Stoics produce an instance of this cognitive grasping that is immune to skeptical counterexamples, that is, immune to scenarios in which a true impression provides the same sensory evidence as its false imitator. Apparently there is a plentiful supply of such counterexamples, and the Academics spent a great deal of effort developing them. (Ac. 2.42) One type illustrates cases of misidentification: for example, identical twins, eggs, statues, or imprints in wax made by the same ring. (Ac. 2.84-87) Another type involves cases of illusion, dreams and madness. (Ac. 2.88-91)

So it seems that any example of an allegedly cognitive impression offered by the Stoics can be countered by the Academics’ doppelganger or a scenario in which some mental defect and not the object is responsible for the perceptual content of the impression. In either case, the Academics challenge the third characteristic above of cognitive impressions. This challenge is evident in Cicero’s report. (Ac. 2.83, cf. 2.40) The Academics agree with the Stoics that some impressions are true and some are false, and that false impressions are never cognitive. They also agree that if there were no differences between two impressions then these impressions must either both be cognitive or both fail to be cognitive, that is, either the perceptual content of both guarantee their truth or fails to guarantee their truth. In other words, if there were no differences between the two impressions it cannot be the case that one is cognitive and the other is not. The crucial premise, and the crux of the debate, is the Academics’ claim, contrary to (3) above, that

(4) for every true impression there may exist a false one that is identical (that is, qualitatively, not numerically).

If we grant (4), then there can be no impression whose perceptual content guarantees its truth; that is, there can be no cognitive impressions. Imagine that you have received an exceedingly clear and distinct impression of an orange. No matter how much you seek to corroborate the truth of this impression, or acquire an even clearer and more distinct impression, it may still turn out to be false. Based on the way it appears, you can never know whether it is a true impression or a false one that is qualitatively identical to the true one. The possibility of error inevitably enters if we must recognize an impression as cognitive for it to play its intended epistemic role.

In response to (4), the Stoics insisted that no two impressions can be identical (Ac. 2.50). So even though two impressions may seem identical, there will still be distinguishable features. In these sorts of cases we must sharpen our skills and refrain from assenting in the meantime (Ac. 2.56-57). But Cicero replies that it makes no difference whether the impressions are strictly identical or only indistinguishable to us (Ac. 2.85). The issue, as he understands it, is whether we are ever actually in a position to accurately identify an impression as cognitive on the basis of its perceptual content.

This interpretation may be unfair to the Stoics however. At one point Lucullus, the spokesman for the Stoics in the Academica, compares assenting to cognitive impressions to the sinking of a scale’s balance when weight is put on it. The mind necessarily yields and cannot refrain from giving its approval to what is perspicuous. (Ac. 2.38) Sextus also attributes this view to later Stoics: when the cognitive impression lacks any obstacles it lays hold of us by the hair and practically drags us to assent. (M 7.257) In the end, assent must still be voluntary. But what these passages suggest is some sort of natural fit between cognitive impressions and our rational faculty such that cognitive impressions are, at least potentially, compelling in a way that false impressions cannot be. According to this view, cognitive impressions affect the properly trained mind in a way that is quite different from the way false impressions affect the same mind. If there is this natural fit between cognitive impressions and our rational faculty, then perhaps it is possible after all to acquire the necessary level of discernment to guarantee that one will only assent to cognitive impressions.

Even so, Cicero was apparently satisfied that the Stoics had not succeeded in showing that cognitive impressions provide us with a criterion of truth in practice. He was more convinced by the seemingly limitless supply of false impressions that we cannot currently distinguish from true ones than by the remote possibility of developing our powers of discernment to overcome such possible deceptions.

3. Indirect Arguments in Support of Stoic Epistemology in the Academica

Lucullus also presents some indirect arguments. He assumes the truth of Cicero’s Academic position (akatalêpsia, that is, the denial of the possibility of katalêpsis) and derives unacceptable consequences. There are two types of such argument: first that akatalêpsia is self-refuting or inconsistent (Ac. 2.33, 44, 58, cf. also 111), and second that akatalêpsia removes the possibility of certain sorts of successful action, especially virtuous action (Ac. 2.19-27, 32-39). These are versions of the two most often repeated arguments against virtually every ancient skeptic. In this context, however, they are specifically tailored as responses to the rejection of the Stoic criterion.

First, consider the charge that akatalêpsia is self-refuting. Lucullus remarks that the Academics’ crucial premise (4) tells us that there are (or at least may be) no differences between any given true impression and a false one. And yet the Academics also claim that some impressions are true and some are false, and this implies that there is some difference between them. (Ac. 2.44) Thus in rejecting katalêpsis, the Academics inconsistently argue that there is and there is not a difference between any given true impression and a false one.

There is an easy rejoinder available. Cicero need only claim that there are no perceptual differences between any given true impression and a false one. This is consistent with saying that there are causal differences, specifically that true impressions come from what is the case and false ones do not. Cicero does not deny that truth exists, but rather that we can grasp it with certainty. (Ac. 2.111) So the problem lies not with the world, but rather with our inability to develop our powers of discernment to the level required by the Stoic theory. No matter how much practice we may have at distinguishing eggs, there may always be a pair of eggs whose similarities exceed our ability.

But Lucullus’ objection is not merely that akatalêpsia entails the impossibility of correctly identifying which of my impressions are true. His objection also includes the claim that akatalêpsia entails the eradication of any adequate conception of truth. (Ac. 2.33) If we have no adequate conception of truth, however, we cannot consistently assert that some impressions are true and some are false. In other words, we should not accept that there is a real distinction between truth and falsity, right and wrong, or any other pair, unless we are confident that our corresponding conceptions of each accurately reveal this distinction. Granting this point, the difficulty for the Stoics lies in explaining why akatalêpsia entails the eradication of any adequate conception of truth in the first place.

Unfortunately, Lucullus does not elaborate on this point. But the explanation must have something to do with the Stoic view of oikeiôsis, the providential process by which Nature guides the moral and intellectual development of all human beings. In sketching the Stoic view of oikeiôsis, we will also arrive at the second sort of objection mentioned above, namely that akatalêpsia removes the possibility of certain sorts of successful action, especially virtuous action.

The Stoics believe that Nature implants in each of us a love of ourselves that is expressed in our primary and earliest drive towards self-preservation. We are naturally disposed to choose what is in accordance with our nature and reject what is opposed or harmful to it. As a result of this innate tendency, we all inevitably develop accurate conceptions (prolêpseis) of what is helpful and what is harmful with respect to self-preservation. This explains, among other things, the instinctive drive of newborns to nurse: the breast is perceived as beneficial.

These naturally developed conceptions must be veridical in keeping with the providence of nature. If they were misleading it would threaten our existence as a species, and it would be impossible to develop such faulty conceptions further into the organized bodies of knowledge exhibited in skillful activity. Nature does not guarantee that we will develop our naturally acquired conceptions into systematic bodies of knowledge and ultimately into virtuous dispositions; neither does Nature guarantee that all acorns will grow into magnificent oaks. But the raw material is provided in both cases.

Assenting to cognitive impressions is essential to the process by which we develop our naturally developed conceptions (prolêpseis) into the more precise conceptions (ennoiai) that regulate our rational judgments. For example, in De Finibus 3, Cicero’s Stoic spokesman Cato describes the process by which our natural disposition towards self-preservation is transformed into a true conception of the good. Our drive for self-preservation leads us to accurate conceptions of what is valuable or beneficial. Then, if we reason correctly about the nature of this value, we gradually discern what is genuinely valuable, the good itself. (De Finibus 3.16 ff.) But again it would not be possible to arrive at a true conception of the good if the raw material were somehow misleading.

Lucullus remarks that the mind “seizes some impressions [presumably cognitive ones] in order to make immediate use of them, others, which are the source of memory, it stores away so to speak, while all the rest it arranges by their likenesses, and thereby conceptions of things are produced…” (Ac. 2.30, tr. Long and Sedley [= LS] 40N) So we arrive at our conceptions in general by performing mental operations on sensory experience. (cf. Diogenes Laertius 7.53) If we cannot rely on the accuracy of sensory experience, that is if we deny the possibility of katalêpsis, then it will be impossible to form an accurate conception of truth, or anything else. This in turn undermines our ability to distinguish the true from the false in general.

Cognitive impressions are thus part of a natural fit between the world and our rational faculties—they indicate a basic or immediate way in which the world is intelligible to us. By denying the existence of cognitive impressions, Lucullus claims the Academics obliterate this crucial link and render the world ultimately unintelligible. They “tear out the very tools or equipment of life, or rather they actually ruin the foundations of the whole of life and rob the living being itself of the mind which gives it life…” (Ac. 2.31, tr. LS 40N) And he asks, if the conceptions that we form on the basis of our experience “were false or imprinted by the kind of impressions which were indiscernible from false ones, how on earth could we make use of them?” (Ac. 2.22, tr. LS 40M, cf. Ac. 2.19-20) Lucullus must mean “how could we successfully make use of them?”—otherwise, we could simply say “poorly and unreliably.” His question presupposes the apparent success we have had in organizing sensory experience into the systematic bodies of knowledge that are employed in skillful activities. To account for this success he thinks we must acknowledge that some impressions are cognitive.

The denial of katalêpsis also eliminates the possibility of virtue or wisdom. If we cannot form an accurate conception of the good, then we can never be sure that any of our particular actions are in fact good. Personifying wisdom, Lucullus remarks that she cannot possibly be wisdom if she is doubtful and in ignorance regarding the ultimate good which provides the measure against which we evaluate everything. (Ac. 2.24) For example, suppose I assent to the proposition that it is good for me to teach my students about skepticism. The Stoics believe that if my conception of the good is incorrect, or even if I do not know whether it is correct, the resulting action is not virtuous. It may be the right thing to do, but virtue requires that I know it is right, and that my conviction is unshakeable by any argument. Katalêpsis provides the basis for such certainty. The denial of katalêpsis thus removes the possibility of virtue.

The most obvious weakness of these objections is the extent to which they presuppose controversial elements of the Stoic system. Unless the skeptical opponent accepts these elements, the objections have no force. But Cicero does respond to these objections, perhaps because he accepts much of the Stoic system, though in the provisional way characteristic of an Academic. In his defense of the Academic position he shows how successful and skillful action and even virtue are possible without katalêpsis.

4. The Positive Fallibilism of the Philonian Academy

The development of a positive alternative to Stoic katalêpsis is generally thought to be the result of a misinterpretation of the earlier Academics’ more radical skepticism, especially Carneades’ skepticism. The radical variety makes no provisions for acquiring beliefs; having successfully refuted every available (if not possible) position, the skeptic’s only option is to suspend judgment and believe nothing. The moderate variety, by contrast, aims at acquiring the most rationally defensible position with the full awareness of one’s fallibility.

Cicero insists that Academics do not deny the existence of true impressions; they deny only the possibility of an infallible grasp of them. He offers no explicit defense for the claim that true impressions exist, but he does recognize the existence of technical expertise; the general accuracy of our impressions would then provide the best explanation for this fact. Thus far he is in agreement with Lucullus: there could be no technical expertise if there were absolutely no distinction between true and false impressions. Technical expertise seems to presuppose that most of the impressions we rely on are in fact true.

Such reliability, however, is completely independent of our ability to infallibly differentiate true from false. As long as we make a responsible and cautious use of our impressions, always allowing for the possibility of error, the occasional deception is no serious cause for alarm.

In response to the Stoic objections that akatalêpsia would lead to inaction, the Academics did suggest that we may get along very well by relying on what appears to be subjectively plausible: Arcesilaus refers to this as what is reasonable (to eulogon), and Carneades as what is plausible (to pithanon). Cicero translates these Greek terms with one of his most important philosophical coinages, probabilitas. Regardless of what his predecessors intended by their skeptical alternatives, Cicero clearly intends that probabilitas is somehow like the truth. He frequently uses probabile and veri simile interchangeably (Ac. 2.7-9, 32, 99, Tusculan Disputations 1.17, 2.5).

Furthermore, he acknowledges that probabilitas is useful both “in the conduct of life and in philosophical investigation and discussion” (Ac. 2.32). So it seems that Cicero is not concerned exclusively with explaining relatively mundane successes like our ability to navigate, or even the more noteworthy successes of science, but also the possibility of making progress philosophically. Indeed, he maintains, both in the Academic books and elsewhere, that virtue is possible without Stoic katalêpsis. This is evident in the character of the “Academic sage.”

The Academic sage “is not afraid lest he may appear to throw everything into confusion and make everything uncertain. For if a question be put to him about duty or about a number of other matters in which practice has made him an expert, he would not reply in the same way as he would if questioned as to whether the number of stars is even or odd, and say that he did not know; for in things uncertain there is nothing probable, but in things where there is probability the wise man will not be at a loss either what to do or what to answer” (Ac. 2.110, tr. by H. Rackham). Guided solely by probabilitas, the sage will plan out his entire life (Ac. 2.99).

Cicero is much less forthcoming with regard to the details of how the sage employs probabilitas in adjudicating competing philosophical claims. But that the sage does employ probabilitas in this way is evident from the fact that he accepts the denial of the possibility of katalêpsis as probable. (Ac. 2.110) Such a decision indicates that the sage has weighed both sides of the debate and arrived at his probable judgment as a result.

It is likely that Cicero is following Philo’s adaptation of Carneades’ account of how we should test our sensory impressions when in doubt. (This is most extensively reported by Sextus Empiricus, M 7.166-189, see also Ac. 2.78). In matters of relatively little importance, or when we don’t have time for a more thorough examination we rely on whatever seems immediately plausible. Even though unexamined, such impressions may strike us with varying degrees of force or vividness. But since every individual impression is accompanied by a host of other related impressions, we should examine these as well, time permitting. When none of these concurrent impressions seem false, or inconsistent with the impression in question, our belief is greater. In matters of the greatest importance, especially those pertaining to our happiness, we should go a step further and examine each of the concurrent impressions individually, cross-questioning each of them on the testimony of the others. (M 7.184)

Impressions that survive this scrutiny are most credible. But the degrees of credibility have no upper limit since cross-questioning may proceed indefinitely. What the higher levels of scrutiny have in common is that they are aimed primarily at disconfirmation (M 7.189). In the end, what reveals itself as most credible is what has survived the most extensive attempts at “refutation.”

Given that Cicero sees himself as engaged in the same philosophical practice as Carneades, it is likely that disconfirmation plays the same central role in the philosophical application of probabilitas as in the empirical application of Carneades’ criterion. So to employ this fallible criterion in philosophical investigation would require a serious and sustained effort to refute the view in question. If it survives such critical scrutiny, it will appear to be like the truth. Since we are dealing with degrees of justification, approximation to the truth most likely refers to the extent to which the view in question has been rationally defended. The further assumption underlying this is that the truth cannot be refuted. Surviving serious attempts at refutation would then provide inductive evidence of the truth of that view, and the more it survives the more it will appear to be like the truth.

Unlike the empirical cases, philosophical issues typically do not force a judgment. We may reflect indefinitely on whether justice is whatever the strong say it is whereas life-and-death, fight-or-flight, judgments cannot wait. This open-endedness is reflected in Cicero’s own consideration of the dispute between the Stoics and Peripatetics on the sufficiency of virtue for a happy [eudaimôn] life. Sometimes he was swayed by the Stoics’ position that virtue can guarantee a happy life with or without external goods like health and wealth. And sometimes he was swayed by the Peripatetic view that virtue requires at least some of those external goods to secure a happy life. The fact that Cicero continued to the end of his life to struggle with this issue does not mean that he failed as an Academic. Arriving once and for all at the philosophical view that can be most consistently maintained is not required; continuing to search for it is.

5. References and Further Reading

a. Latin Texts and Translations

Brittain, C., tr. 2006. Cicero: On Academic Scepticism, Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing.
Long and Sedley, tr. 1987. The Hellenistic Philosophers, Volumes 1 and 2, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
- Long and Sedley provide translations of and commentary on a good portion of the Academica. Their volumes are indispensable to the study of Hellenistic philosophy in general, and the commentary on the selections from the Academica are extremely helpful.
Rackham, H., tr. 1933/1994. Cicero: De Natura Deorum, Academica, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
- This volume in the Loeb Classical Library contains the Latin text with English translation on facing pages. It is currently the only English translation available of the Academic books in their entirety (as we have them).
Reid, J. S. 1885. M. Tulli Ciceronis, Academica, London: MacMillan.
- For textual analysis and philosophical commentary, Reid’s edition is still valuable.

b. Select Bibliography of Secondary Literature

Brittain, C. 2001. Philo of Larissa: the Last of the Academic Sceptics, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- Though Brittain does not deal specifically with Cicero as a philosopher, he makes extensive use of the Academic books in reconstructing the positions held by Philo as well as the history of the Academy in general. This is a very carefully researched and comprehensive book. In addition to presenting a stimulating reconstruction of Philo’s views, there is a very useful appendix containing all the testimonia on Philo along with translations.
Glucker, J. 1978. Antiochus and the Late Academy, Hypomnemata 56, Göttingen.
Glucker, J. 1988. “Cicero’s Philosophical Affiliations,” in Dillon, J.M. and A.A. Long, eds., The Question of “Eclecticism”: Studies in Later Greek Philosophy, Berkeley.
Glucker, J. 1995. “Probabile, Veri Simile, and Related Terms,” in Powell, ed.
Görler, W. 1995. “Silencing the troublemaker: De Legibus 1.39 and the Continuity of Cicero’s Scepticism,” in Powell, ed.
- This is a response to an earlier article by Glucker which argues that Cicero changed his affiliation twice, once from a youthful adherence to the skeptical Academy to the more dogmatic position of Antiochus, and then later in life back again.
Mansfeld, J. and B. Inwood, eds. 1997. Assent and Argument: Studies in Cicero’s Academic Books, Leiden: Brill.
- This and the following volume are highly recommended as a starting point for further study in Cicero’s skepticism and the late Academy in general.
Powell, J.G.F., ed. 1995. Cicero the Philosopher, Oxford.
Tarrant, H. 1985. Scepticism or Platonism, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.

Author Information

Harald Thorsrud
Email: hthorsrud@agnesscott.edu
New Mexico State University
U. S. A.

Divine Command Theory

Philosophers both past and present have sought to defend theories of ethics that are grounded in a theistic framework. Roughly, Divine Command Theory is the view that morality is somehow dependent upon God, and that moral obligation consists in obedience to God’s commands. Divine Command Theory includes the claim that morality is ultimately based on the commands or character of God, and that the morally right action is the one that God commands or requires. The specific content of these divine commands varies according to the particular religion and the particular views of the individual divine command theorist, but all versions of the theory hold in common the claim that morality and moral obligations ultimately depend on God.

Divine Command Theory has been and continues to be highly controversial. It has been criticized by numerous philosophers, including Plato, Kai Nielsen, and J. L. Mackie. The theory also has many defenders, both classic and contemporary, such as Thomas Aquinas, Robert Adams, and Philip Quinn. The question of the possible connections between religion and ethics is of interest to moral philosophers as well as philosophers of religion, but it also leads us to consider the role of religion in society as well as the nature of moral deliberation. Given this, the arguments offered for and against Divine Command Theory have both theoretical and practical importance.

Modern Moral Philosophy
Some Possible Advantages of Divine Command Theory
A Persistent Problem: The Euthyphro Dilemma
Responses to the Euthyphro Dilemma
Speech Acts and Obligations to Act
Ethics Without God
Other Objections to Divine Command Theory
Conclusion: Religion, Morality, and the Good Life
References and Further Reading

1. Modern Moral Philosophy

In her influential paper, “Modern Moral Philosophy,” Elizabeth Anscombe (1958) argues that moral terms such as “should” and “ought” acquired a legalistic sense (that is, being bound by law) because of Christianity’s far-reaching historical influence and its legalistic conception of ethics. For example, use of the term “ought” seems to suggest a verdict on an action, and this in turn suggests a judge. On a law conception of ethics, conformity with the virtues requires obeying the divine law. A divine law requires the existence of God, as the divine lawgiver. Anscombe claims that since we have given up on God’s existence, we should also give up the use of moral terms that are derived from a theistic worldview. Since we have given up belief in God, we should also give up the moral understanding that rests on such belief, and engage in moral philosophy without using such terms. For Anscombe, this meant that we should abandon talk of morality as law, and instead focus on morality as virtue.

Alan Donagan (1977) argues against these conclusions. Donagan’s view is that Anscombe was mistaken on two counts. First, he rejects her claim that we can only treat morality as a system of law if we also presuppose the existence of a divine lawgiver. Second, Donagan contends that neither must we abandon law-based conceptions of morality for an Aristotelian virtue ethic. The reason for this, according to Donagan, is that a divine command must express God’s reason in order for it to be expressive of a divine law. Given this, if we assume that human reason is at least in principle adequate for directing our lives, then the substance of divine law that is relevant to human life can be appreciated with human reason, apart from any reference to a divine being. Moreover, according to Donagan, even if we conceive of morality as Aristotle did, namely, as a matter of virtue, it is quite natural to think that each virtue has as its counterpart some moral rule or precept. For example, ‘to act in manner x is to be just’ has as its counterpart ‘to act in manner x is morally right’. And if we can apprehend the relevant moral virtue via human reason, then we can also apprehend the relevant moral law by that same reason. Given the foregoing points raised by Anscombe and Donagan, a divine command theorist might opt for a conception of morality as virtue, as law, or both.

Before looking at some possible advantages of Divine Command Theory, it will be helpful to clarify further the content of the view. Edward Wierenga (1989) points out that there are many ways to conceive of the connection between God and morality. A strong version of Divine Command Theory includes the claim that moral statements (x is obligatory) are defined in terms of theological statements (x is commanded by God). At the other end of the spectrum is the view that the commands of God are coextensive with the demands of morality. God’s commands do not determine morality, but rather inform us about its content. Wierenga opts for a view that lies between these strong and weak versions of Divine Command Theory. In what follows, I will, following Wierenga, take Divine Command Theory to include the following claims: (i) God in some sense determines what is moral; (ii) moral obligations are derived from God’s commands, where these commands are understood as statements of the revealed divine will.

2. Some Possible Advantages of Divine Command Theory

In his Critique of Practical Reason, Immanuel Kant, who has traditionally not been seen as an advocate of Divine Command Theory (for an opposing view see Nuyen, 1998), claims that morality requires faith in God and an afterlife. According to Kant, we must believe that God exists because the requirements of morality are too much for us to bear. We must believe that there is a God who will help us satisfy the demands of the moral law. With such a belief, we have the hope that we will be able to live moral lives. Moreover, Kant argues that “there is not the slightest ground in the moral law for a necessary connection between the morality and proportionate happiness of a being who belongs to the world as one of its parts and is thus dependent on it” (p. 131). However, if there is a God and an afterlife where the righteous are rewarded with happiness and justice obtains, this problem goes away. That is, being moral does not guarantee happiness, so we must believe in a God who will reward the morally righteous with happiness. Kant does not employ the concept of moral faith as an argument for Divine Command Theory, but a contemporary advocate could argue along Kantian lines that these advantages do accrue to this view of morality.

Another possible advantage of Divine Command Theory is that it provides an objective metaphysical foundation for morality. For those committed to the existence of objective moral truths, such truths seem to fit well within a theistic framework. That is, if the origin of the universe is a personal moral being, then the existence of objective moral truths are at home, so to speak, in the universe. By contrast, if the origin of the universe is non-moral, then the existence of such truths becomes philosophically perplexing, because it is unclear how moral properties can come into existence via non-moral origins. Given the metaphysical insight that ex nihilo, nihilo fit, the resulting claim is that out of the non-moral, nothing moral comes. Objective moral properties stick out due to a lack of naturalness of fit in an entirely naturalistic universe. This perspective assumes that objective moral properties exist, which is of course highly controversial.

Not only does Divine Command Theory provide a metaphysical basis for morality, but according to many it also gives us a good answer to the question, why be moral? William Lane Craig argues that this is an advantage of a view of ethics that is grounded in God. On theism, we are held accountable for our actions by God. Those who do evil will be punished, and those who live morally upstanding lives will be vindicated and even rewarded. Good, in the end, triumphs over evil. Justice will win out. Moreover, on a theistic view of ethics, we have a reason to act in ways that run counter to our self-interest, because such actions of self-sacrifice have deep significance and merit within a theistic framework. On Divine Command Theory it is therefore rational to sacrifice my own well-being for the well-being of my children, my friends, and even complete strangers, because God approves of and even commands such acts of self-sacrifice.

An important objection to the foregoing points is that there is something inadequate about a punishment and reward orientation of moral motivation. That is, one might argue that if the motive for being moral on Divine Command Theory is to merely avoid punishment and perhaps gain eternal bliss, then this is less than ideal as an account of moral motivation, because it is a mark of moral immaturity. Should we not instead seek to live moral lives in community with others because we value them and desire their happiness? In response to this, advocates of Divine Command Theory may offer different accounts of moral motivation, agreeing that a moral motivation based solely on reward and punishment is inadequate. For example, perhaps the reason to be moral is that God designed human beings to be constituted in such a way that being moral is a necessary condition for human flourishing. Some might object that this is overly egoistic, but at any rate it seems less objectionable than the motivation to be moral provided by the mere desire to avoid punishment. Augustine (see Kent, 2001) develops a view along these lines. Augustine begins with the notion that ethics is the pursuit of the supreme good, which provides the happiness that all humans seek. He then claims that the way to obtain this happiness is to love the right objects, that is, those that are worthy of our love, in the right way. In order to do this, we must love God, and then we will be able to love our friends, physical objects, and everything else in the right way and in the right amount. On Augustine’s view, love of God helps us to orient our other loves in the proper way, proportional to their value. However, even if these points in defense of Divine Command Theory are thought to be satisfactory, there is another problem looming for the view that was famously discussed by Plato over two thousand years ago.

3. A Persistent Problem: The Euthyphro Dilemma

The dialogue between Socrates and Euthyphro is nearly omnipresent in philosophical discussions of the relationship between God and ethics. In this dialogue, written by Plato (1981), who was a student of Socrates, Euthyphro and Socrates encounter each other in the king’s court. Charges have been brought against Socrates by Miletus, who claims that Socrates is guilty of corrupting the youth of Athens by leading them away from belief in the proper gods. In the course of their conversation, Socrates is surprised to discover that Euthyphro is prosecuting his own father for the murder of a servant. Euthyphro’s family is upset with him because of this, and they believe that what he is doing—prosecuting his own father—is impious. Euthyphro maintains that his family fails to understand the divine attitude to his action. This then sets the stage for a discussion of the nature of piety between Socrates and Euthyphro. In this discussion, Socrates asks Euthyphro the now philosophically famous question that he and any divine command theorist must consider: “Is the pious loved by the gods because it is pious, or is it pious because it is loved by the gods?” (p. 14).

For our purposes, it will be useful to rephrase Socrates’ question. Socrates can be understood as asking “Does God command this particular action because it is morally right, or is it morally right because God commands it?” It is in answering this question that the divine command theorist encounters a difficulty. A defender of Divine Command Theory might respond that an action is morally right because God commands it. However, the implication of this response is that if God commanded that we inflict suffering on others for fun, then doing so would be morally right. We would be obligated to do so, because God commanded it. This is because, on Divine Command Theory, the reason that inflicting such suffering is wrong is that God commands us not to do it. However, if God commanded us to inflict such suffering, doing so would become the morally right thing to do. The problem for this response to Socrates’ question, then, is that God’s commands and therefore the foundations of morality become arbitrary, which then allows for morally reprehensible actions to become morally obligatory.

Most advocates of Divine Command Theory do not want to be stuck with the implication that cruelty could possibly be morally right, nor do they want to accept the implication that the foundations of morality are arbitrary. So, a divine command theorist might avoid this problem of arbitrariness by opting for a different answer to Socrates’ question, and say that for any particular action that God commands, He commands it because it is morally right. By taking this route, the divine command theorist avoids having to accept that inflicting suffering on others for fun could be a morally right action. More generally, she avoids the arbitrariness that plagues any Divine Command Theory which includes the claim that an action is right solely because God commands it. However, two new problems now arise. If God commands a particular action because it is morally right, then ethics no longer depends on God in the way that Divine Command Theorists maintain. God is no longer the author of ethics, but rather a mere recognizer of right and wrong. As such, God no longer serves as the foundation of ethics. Moreover, it now seems that God has become subject to an external moral law, and is no longer sovereign. John Arthur (2005) puts the point this way: “If God approves kindness because it is a virtue and hates the Nazis because they were evil, then it seems that God discovers morality rather than inventing it” (20, emphasis added). God is no longer sovereign over the entire universe, but rather is subject to a moral law external to himself. The notion that God is subject to an external moral law is also a problem for theists who hold that in the great chain of being, God is at the top. Here, there is a moral law external to and higher than God, and this is a consequence that many divine command theorists would want to reject. Hence, the advocate of a Divine Command Theory of ethics faces a dilemma: morality either rests on arbitrary foundations, or God is not the source of ethics and is subject to an external moral law, both of which allegedly compromise his supreme moral and metaphysical status.

4. Responses to the Euthyphro Dilemma

a. Bite the Bullet

One possible response to the Euthyphro Dilemma is to simply accept that if God does command cruelty, then inflicting it upon others would be morally obligatory. In Super 4 Libros Sententiarum, William of Ockham states that the actions which we call “theft” and “adultery” would be obligatory for us if God commanded us to do them. Most people find this to be an unacceptable view of moral obligation, on the grounds that any theory of ethics that leaves open the possibility that such actions are morally praiseworthy is fatally flawed. However, as Robert Adams (1987) points out, a full understanding of Ockham’s view here would emphasize that it is a mere logical possibility that God could command adultery or cruelty, and not a real possibility. That is, even if it is logically possible that God could command cruelty, it is not something that God will do, given his character in the actual world. Given this, Ockham himself was surely not prepared to inflict suffering on others if God commanded it. Even with this proviso, however, many reject this type of response to the Euthyphro Dilemma.

b. Human Nature

Another response to the Euthyphro Dilemma which is intended to avoid the problem of arbitrariness is discussed by Clark and Poortenga (2003), drawing upon the moral theory of Thomas Aquinas. If we conceive of the good life for human beings as consisting in activities and character qualities that fulfill us, then the good life will depend upon our nature, as human beings. Given human nature, some activities and character traits will fulfill us, and some will not. For example, neither drinking gasoline nor lying nor committing adultery will help us to function properly and so be fulfilled, as human beings. God created us with a certain nature. Once he has done this, he cannot arbitrarily decide what is good or bad for us, what will help or hinder us from functioning properly. God could have created us differently. That is, it is possible that he could have made us to thrive and be fulfilled by ingesting gasoline, lying, and committing adultery. But, according to Aquinas, he did no such thing. We must live lives marked by a love for God and other people, if we want to be fulfilled as human beings. The defender of this type of response to the Euthyphro Dilemma, to avoid the charge of arbitrariness, should explain why God created us with the nature that we possess, rather than some other nature. What grounded this decision? A satisfactory answer will include the claim that there is something valuable about human beings and the nature that we possess that grounded God’s decision, but it is incumbent upon the proponent of this response to defend this claim.

c. Alston’s Advice

In his “Some Suggestions for Divine Command Theorists”, William Alston (1990) offers some advice to advocates of Divine Command Theory, which Alston believes will make the view as philosophically strong as it can be. Alston formulates the Euthyphro dilemma as a question regarding which of the two following statements a divine command theorist should accept:

1. We ought to love one another because God commands us to do so.

or

2. God commands us to love one another because that is what we ought to do.

Alston’s argument is that if we interpret these statements correctly, a theist can in fact grasp both horns of this putative dilemma. One problem with opting for number 1 in the above dilemma is that it becomes difficult if not impossible to conceive of God as morally good, because if the standards of moral goodness are set by God’s commands, then the claim “God is morally good” is equivalent to “God obeys His own commands”. But this trivialization is not what we mean when we assert that God is morally good. Alston argues that a divine command theorist can avoid this problem by conceiving of God’s moral goodness as something distinct from conformity to moral obligations, and so as something distinct from conformity to divine commands. Alston summarizes his argument for this claim as follows:

…a necessary condition of the truth that ‘S ought to do A’ is at least the metaphysical possibility that S does not do A. On this view, moral obligations attach to all human beings, even those so saintly as to totally lack any tendency, in the ordinary sense of that term, to do other than what it is morally good to do. And no moral obligations attach to God, assuming, as we are here, that God is essentially perfectly good. Thus divine commands can be constitutive of moral obligations for those beings who have them without it being the case that God’s goodness consists in His obeying His own commands, or, indeed, consists in any relation whatsoever of God to His commands (p. 315).

Alston concludes that Divine Command Theory survives the first horn of the dilemma. However, in so doing, perhaps the theory is delivered a fatal blow by the dilemma’s second horn. If the divine command theorist holds that “God commands us to love our neighbor because it is morally good that we should do so,” then moral goodness is independent of God’s will and moral facts stand over God, so to speak, insofar as God is now subject to such facts. Hence, God is no longer absolutely sovereign. One response is to say that God is subject to moral principles in the same way that he is subject to logical principles, which nearly all agree does not compromise his sovereignty (See The Omnipotence Objection below). Alston prefers a different option, however, and argues that we can think of God himself as the supreme standard of goodness. God does not consult some independent Platonic realm where the objective principles of goodness exist, but rather God just acts according to his necessarily good character. But is not arbitrariness still present, insofar as it seems that it is arbitrary to take a particular individual as the standard of goodness, without reference to the individual’s conformity to general principles of goodness? In response, Alston points out that there must be a stopping point for any explanation. That is, sooner or later, when we are seeking an answer to the question “By virtue of what does good supervene on these characteristics?” we ultimately reach either a general principle or an individual paradigm. And Alston’s view is that it is no more arbitrary to invoke God as the supreme moral standard than it is to invoke some supreme moral principle. That is, the claim that good supervenes on God is no more arbitrary than the claim that it supervenes on some Platonic principle.

d. Modified Divine Command Theory

Robert Adams (1987) has offered a modified version of the Divine Command Theory, which a defender of the theory can appropriate in response to the Euthyphro Dilemma. Adams argues that a modified divine command theorist “wants to say…that an act is wrong if and only if it is contrary to God’s will or commands (assuming God loves us)” (121). Moreover, Adams claims that the following is a necessary truth: “Any action is ethically wrong if and only if it is contrary to the commands of a loving God” (132). On this modification of Divine Command Theory, actions, and perhaps intentions and individuals, possess the property of ethical wrongness, and this property is an objective property. That is, an action such as torturing someone for fun is ethically wrong, irrespective of whether anyone actually believes that it is wrong, and it is wrong because it is contrary to the commands of a loving God.

One could agree with this modification of Divine Command Theory, but disagree with the claim that it is a necessary truth that any action is ethically wrong if and only if it is contrary to the commands of a loving God. One might hold that this claim is a contingent truth, that is, that in the actual world, being contrary to the commands of a loving God is what constitutes ethical wrongness, but that there are other possible worlds in which ethical wrongness is not identified with being contrary to the commands of a loving God. It should be pointed out that for the theist who wants to argue from the existence of objective moral properties back to the existence of God, Adams’ stronger claim, namely, that an action is wrong if and only if it goes against the commands of a loving God, should be taken as a necessary truth, rather than a contingent one.

At any rate, whichever option a modified divine command theorist chooses, the modification at issue is aimed at avoiding both horns of the Euthyphro Dilemma. The first horn of the dilemma posed by Socrates to Euthyphro is that if an act is morally right because God commands it, then morality becomes arbitrary. Given this, we could be morally obligated to inflict cruelty upon others. The Modified Divine Command Theory avoids this problem, because morality is not based on the mere commands of God, but is rooted in the unchanging omnibenevolent nature of God. Hence, morality is not arbitrary nor would God command cruelty for its own sake, because God’s nature is fixed and unchanging, and to do so would violate it. It is not possible for a loving God to command cruelty for its own sake. The Modified Divine Command Theory is also thought to avoid the second horn of the Euthyphro Dilemma. God is the source of morality, because morality is grounded in the character of God. Moreover, God is not subject to a moral law that exists external to him. On the Modified Divine Command Theory, the moral law is a feature of God’s nature. Given that the moral law exists internal to God, in this sense, God is not subject to an external moral law, but rather is that moral law. God therefore retains his supreme moral and metaphysical status. Morality, for the modified divine command theorist, is ultimately grounded in the perfect nature of God.

5. Speech Acts and Obligations to Act

Philip Quinn (1978, 1998) offers the following two statements, which he takes to be equivalent:

The moral law imposes the obligation that p.
God commands that p.

For Quinn, then, an agent is obliged to p just in case God commands that p. God is the source of moral obligation. Quinn illustrates and expands on this claim by examining scriptural stories in which God commands some action that apparently violates a previous divine command. Consider God’s command to the Israelites to plunder the Egyptians reported in Exodus 11:2. This seems to go against God’s previous command, contained within the Ten Commandments, against theft. One response to this offered by Quinn is to claim that since theft involves taking what is not due one, and God commanded the Israelites to plunder the Egyptians, their plunder of the Egyptians does not count as theft. The divine command makes obligatory an action that would have been wrong apart from that command. Such moral power is not available to human beings, because only God has such moral authority by virtue of the divine nature.

Elsewhere, Quinn (1979) considers a different relationship between divine commands and moral obligations. Rather than equivalence, Quinn offers a causal theory in which our moral obligations are created by divine commands or acts of will: “…a sufficient causal condition that it is obligatory that p is that God commands that p, and a necessary causal condition that it is obligatory that p is that God commands that p” (312).

Quinn’s accounts lead us to the question of the relationship between speech acts and obligations to act, discussed by philosophers such as Rawls (1999) and Searle (1969). Consider the act of making a promise. If S promises R to do a, is this sufficient for S incurring an obligation to do a? On the account offered by Rawls, under certain conditions, the answer is yes. Just as rules govern games, there is a public system of rules that governs the institution of promising, such that when S promises R to do a, the rule is that S ought to do a, unless certain conditions obtain which excuse S from this obligation. If S is to make a genuine promise that is morally binding, S must be fully conscious, rational, aware of the meaning and use of the relevant words, and free from coercion. For Rawls, promising allows us to enter into stable cooperative agreements that are mutually advantageous. If the institution of promise making is just, then Rawls argues that the principle of fairness applies. For Rawls, the principle of fairness states that “a person is required to do his part as defined by the rules of an institution when two conditions are met: first, the institution is just (or fair)…and second, one has voluntarily accepted the benefits of the arrangement or taken advantage of the opportunities it offers to further one’s interests” (96). If these conditions are met, then S does incur an obligation to do a by virtue of S’s promise to R.

What implications does the above have for Divine Command Theory? Speech acts can entail obligations, as we have seen with respect to the institution of promise making. However, the case of divine commands is asymmetrical to the case of promising. That is, rather than incurring obligations by our own speech acts, Divine Command Theory tells us that we incur obligations by the communicative acts of another, namely, God. How might this work?

An advocate of Divine Command Theory might argue that some of Rawls points apply to the obligations created by the communicative acts of God. For example, our divine command theorist might claim that if God commands S to do a, S must do a if S meets Rawls’ demands of full consciousness, rationality, awareness of the meaning and use of the relevant words, and freedom from coercion. The rule of fairness applies and its demands are satisfied, according to our divine command theorist, because she holds that the institution of obedience to God’s commands is just and fair, given God’s nature, and because S has voluntarily accepted the benefits of this arrangement with God or taken advantage of the opportunities afforded by the arrangement to further her own interests. So, if S has consented to be a follower of a particular religion, and if the requirements of that religion are just and fair, and if S benefits from this arrangement, then S can incur obligations via divine commands. The upshot is not that the foregoing religious and metaphysical claims are true, but rather that by applying some of Rawls’ claims about promise making, we are able to recognize a possible connection between divine commands and the obligation to perform an action. In the next section, Kai Nielsen challenges the truth of these claims, as well as the overall plausibility of Divine Command Theory.

6. Ethics Without God

In his Ethics Without God, Kai Nielsen (1973) argues against the Divine Command Theory and espouses the view that morality cannot be dependent on the will of God. Nielsen advances an argument for the claim that religion and morality are logically independent. Nielsen admits that it may certainly be prudent to obey the commands of any powerful person, including God. However, it does not follow that such obedience is morally obligatory. For a command of God’s to be relevant to our moral obligations in any particular instance, God must be good. And while the religious believer does maintain that God is good, Nielsen wants to know the basis for such a belief. In response, a believer might claim that she knows God is good because the Bible teaches this, or because Jesus embodied and displayed God’s goodness, or that the world contains evidence in support of the claim that God is good. However, these responses show that the believer herself has some logically prior criterion of goodness based on something apart from the mere fact that God exists or that God created the universe. Otherwise, how does she know that her other beliefs about the Bible, Jesus, or the state of the world support her belief that God is good? Alternatively, the religious believer might simply assert that the statement “God is good” is analytic, that is, that it is a truth of language. The idea here is that we are logically prohibited from calling any entity “God” if that entity is not good in the relevant sense. In this way, the claim “God is good” is similar to the claim “Bachelors are unmarried males.” But now another problem arises for the religious believer, according to Nielsen. In order to properly refer to some entity as “God,” we must already have an understanding of what it is for something to be good. We must already possess a criterion for making judgments of moral goodness, apart from the will of God. Put another way, when we say that we know God is good we must use some independent moral criterion to ground this judgment. So, morality is not based on God because we need a criterion of goodness that is not derived from God’s nature. It follows that God and morality are independent.

Nielsen considers another possibility that remains open to the divine command theorist: she might concede that ethics does not necessarily depend on God, but maintain that God is required for the existence of an adequate morality, that is, one that satisfies our most persistent moral demands. If we take happiness to be the ultimate aim of all human activity, then the ultimate aim of all of our moral activity is also happiness. The divine command theorist can then claim that the mistake of Nielsen and other secular moralists is that they fail to see that only in God can we as human beings find ultimate and lasting happiness. God gives purpose to our lives, and we are fulfilled in loving God. Given this fact of human nature, the divine command theorist can argue that only by faith in God can we find purpose in life. Goodness may not be identical with the will of God, but loving God is the reason we exist. On this account, we need God to be fulfilled and truly happy. We are secure in the knowledge that the universe is not against us, ultimately, but rather that God will guide us, protect us, and care for us. This frees us from anxiety, and enables us to direct our lives towards genuine happiness by living according to the will of God in friendship with God. While from a secular perspective it may seem irrational to live according to an other-regarding ethic, from the viewpoint of the religious believer it is rational because it fulfills our human nature and makes us genuinely happy.

In response to this, Nielsen argues that we simply do not have evidence for the existence of God. Without such evidence, the religious believer’s claim that human nature is truly fulfilled in relationship to God is groundless (for more on the issues Nielsen raises, see Moreland and Nielsen, 1990). Moreover, people can, have, and do live purposeful lives apart from belief in God. Religious faith is not necessary for having a life of purpose. Nielsen adds the skeptical doubt that human beings do not have any ultimate function that we must fulfill to be truly happy. We were not made for anything. This realization need not lead us to nihilism, however. For Nielsen, the notion that in order to have a purpose for our lives there must be a God trades on a confusion. Nielsen argues that even if there is no purpose of life, there can still be a purpose in life. While there may not be a purpose for humans qua humans, we can still have purpose in another sense. That is, we can have purpose in life because we have goals, intentions, and motives. Life is purposeless in the larger sense, but in this more restricted sense it is not, and so things matter to us, even if God does not exist. Life has no Purpose, but our lives can still have purpose. A divine command theorist would likely challenge Nielsen’s view that purpose in the latter sense is sufficient for human flourishing.

7. Other Objections to Divine Command Theory

a. The Omnipotence Objection

An implication of the Modified Divine Command Theory is that God would not, and indeed cannot, command cruelty for its own sake. Some would argue that this implication is inconsistent with the belief that God is omnipotent. How could there be anything that an all-powerful being cannot do?

In his discussion of the omnipotence of God, Thomas Aquinas responds to this understanding of omnipotence, and argues that it is misguided. Aquinas argues that we must consider “the precise meaning of ‘all’ when we say that God can do all things” (First Part, Question 25, Article 3). For Aquinas, to say that God can do all things is to say that he can do all things that are possible, and not those that are impossible. For example, God cannot make a round corner, because this is absolutely impossible. Since “a round corner” is a contradiction in terms, it is better to say that making a round corner cannot be done, rather than God cannot make such a thing. This response, however, is insufficient for the issue at hand, namely, that on a Modified Divine Command Theory, God would not and cannot command cruelty for its own sake. There is no logical contradiction in terms here, as there is in the case of the round corner. Aquinas offers a further response to this sort of challenge to God’s omnipotence. His view is that “to sin is to fall short of a perfect action; which is repugnant to omnipotence” (Ibid). For Aquinas, there is something about the nature of sin (a category in which commanding cruelty for its own sake would fall) that is contrary to omnipotence. Hence, that God cannot do immoral actions is not a limit on his power, but rather it is entailed by his omnipotence. Aquinas’ view is that God cannot command cruelty because he is omnipotent.

b. The Omnibenevolence Objection

On Divine Command Theory, it problematically appears that God’s goodness consists in God doing whatever he wills to do. This problem has been given voice by Leibniz (1951), and has recently been discussed by Quinn (1978), Wierenga (1989), Alston (1989), and Wainright (2005). The problem is this: if what it means for an action to be morally required is that it be commanded by God, then God’s doing what he is obligated to do is equivalent to his doing what he commands himself to do. This, however, is incoherent. While it makes sense to conceive of God as forming an intention to do an action, or judging that it would be good to do an action, the notion that he commands himself to do an action is incoherent. Moreover, on Divine Command Theory, God could not be seen as possessing moral virtues, because a moral virtue would be a disposition to do an action that God commands. This is also incoherent.

In response, divine command theorists have argued that they can still make sense of God’s goodness, by pointing out that he possesses traits which are good as distinguished from being morally obligatory. For example, God may be disposed to love human beings, treat them with compassion, and deal with them fairly. These dispositions are good, even if they are not grounded in a disposition to obey God. And if we take these dispositions to be essential to God’s nature, that is, if they are possessed by God in every possible world in which God exists, then, as Wierenga (1989) points out, while it is still the case that whatever God does is good, “the range of ‘whatever God were to do’ includes no actions for which God would not be praiseworthy” (p. 222). Wainright (2005) explains further that while it is true that the moral obligatoriness of truth telling could not have been God’s reason for commanding it, the claim that God does not have moral reasons for commanding it does not follow. This is because the moral goodness of truth telling is a sufficient reason for God to command it. Once God does command it, truth telling is not only morally good, but it also becomes morally obligatory, on Divine Command Theory.

c. The Autonomy Objection

The idea that to be morally mature, one must freely decide which moral principles will govern one’s life serves as an objection to Divine Command Theory, because on the theory it is not our own wills that govern our moral lives, but the will of God. We are no longer self-legislating beings in the moral realm, but instead followers of a moral law imposed on us from the outside. In this sense, autonomy is incompatible with Divine Command Theory, insofar as on the theory we do not impose the moral law upon ourselves. However, Adams (1999) argues that Divine Command Theory and moral responsibility are compatible, because we are responsible for obeying or not obeying God’s commands, correctly understanding and applying them, and adopting a self-critical stance with respect to what God has commanded us to do. Given this, we are autonomous because we must rely on our own independent judgments about God’s goodness and what moral laws are in consistent with God’s commands. Additionally, it seems that a divine command theorist can still say that we impose the moral law on ourselves by our agreeing to subject ourselves to it once we come to understand it, even if it ultimately is grounded in God’s commands.

d. The Pluralism Objection

The last objection to note is that given the variety and number of religions in the world, how does the divine command theorist know which (putatively) divine commands to follow? The religions of the world often give conflicting accounts of the nature and content of the commands of God. Moreover, even if such a person believes that her religion is correct, there remains a plurality of understandings within religious traditions with respect to what God commands us to do. In response, some of the issues raised above regarding autonomy are relevant. A divine command theorist must decide for herself, based on the available evidence, which understanding of the divine to adopt and which understanding of divine commands within her particular tradition she finds to be the most compelling. This is similar to the activity and deliberation of a secular moralist who must also decide for herself, among a plurality of moral traditions and interpretations within those traditions, which moral principles to adopt and allow to govern her life. This takes us into another problem for divine command theory, namely, that it is only those who follow the correct religion, and the correct interpretation of that religion, that are moral, which seems highly problematic. However, Divine Command Theory is consistent with the belief that numerous religions contain moral truth, and that we can come to know our moral obligations apart from revelation, tradition, and religious practice. For example, a divine command theorist could grant that a philosophical naturalist may come to see that beneficence is intrinsically good through a rational insight into the necessary character of reality (see Austin, 2003). It is consistent with Divine Command Theory that we can come to see our obligations in this and many other ways, and not merely through a religious text, religious experience, or religious tradition.

8. Conclusion: Religion, Morality, and the Good Life

In his A Just Society (2004), Michael Boylan argues that we must engage in self-analysis for the purpose of both constructing and implementing a personal plan of life that is coherent, comprehensive, and good. In this activity, we must recognize that there are many types of values by which we live, including but not limited to religious, ethical, and aesthetic values. Of particular interest in this context is Boylan’s discussion of God’s command to Abraham to kill Isaac. Here we have a conflict between the religious and the ethical. Boylan notes that in the story, Abraham does not kill Isaac, but if he had his community must judge him to be a murderer. The reason for this is that Abraham’s community does not know whether the command to kill Isaac was a legitimate divine command, or some delusion of Abraham’s. So, this community must depend upon the ethical prohibition against murder when evaluating Abraham’s actions. Boylan’s position contrasts with Kierkegaard’s, who is generally interpreted as believing that Abraham’s action is justified by a suspension of the ethical, so that in this case the religious trumps the ethical. However, in such disputes, Boylan argues that when the commands of religion (or the values of aesthetics) clash with the demands of morality, in a just society morality should win the day.

Regardless of what one makes of this, when evaluating the philosophical merits and drawbacks of Divine Command Theory, one should take a broad perspective and consider the possible connections between the theory and other religious and moral issues, as well as the relevant aesthetic, epistemic, and metaphysical questions, in order to develop a personal plan of life that is coherent, comprehensive, and good.

9. References and Further Reading

Adams, Robert M. 1987. The Virtue of Faith and Other Essays in Philosophical Theology. New York: Oxford University Press.
Adams, Robert M. 1999. Finite and Infinite Goods. New York: Oxford University Press.
Alston, William. 1989. Divine Nature and Human Language: Essays in Philosophical Theology. Ithaca, N.Y.: Cornell University Press.
Alston, William. 1990. “Some Suggestions for Divine Command Theorists.” In Christian Theism and the Problems of Philosophy. Edited by Michael Beaty. Notre Dame, Ind.: University of Notre Dame Press: 303-326.
Anscombe, G. E. M. 1958. “Modern Moral Philosophy.” Philosophy 33: 1-19.
Arthur, John. 2005. “Morality, Religion, and Conscience.” In Morality and Moral Controversies: Readings in Moral, Social, and Political Philosophy. Edited by John Arthur. Seventh edition. Upper Saddle River, N.J.: Pearson Prentice Hall: 15-23.
Audi, Robert and William Wainwright. 1986. Rationality, Religious Belief, and Moral Commitment. Ithaca, N.Y.: Cornell University Press.
Austin, Michael W. 2003. “On the Alleged Irrationality of Ethical Intuitionism: Are Ethical Intuitions Epistemically Suspect?” Southwest Philosophy Review 19: 205-213.
Beaty, Michael, ed. 1990. Christian Theism and the Problems of Philosophy. Notre Dame, Ind.: University of Notre Dame Press.
Beaty, Michael, Carlton Fisher, and Mark Nelson, eds. 1998. Christian Theism and Moral Philosophy. Macon, Geo.: Mercer University Press.
Boylan, Michael. 2004. A Just Society. Lanham, Md.: Rowman and Littlefield.
Clark, Kelly James and Anne Poortenga. 2003. The Story of Ethics: Fulfilling Our Human Nature. Upper Saddle River, N.J.: Prentice Hall.
Copan, Paul. 2003. “Morality and Meaning Without God: Another Failed Attempt.” Philosophia Christi Series 2, 6: 295-304.
Donagan, Alan. 1977. The Theory of Morality. Chicago: The University of Chicago Press.
Hare, John. 1997. The Moral Gap: Kantian Ethics, Human Limits, and God’s Assistance. New York: Oxford University Press.
Hare, John. 2000. “Naturalism and Morality.” In Naturalism: A Critical Analysis. Edited by William Lane Craig and J. P. Moreland. New York: Routledge: 189-212.
Kant, Immanuel. 1993. Critique of Practical Reason. Third Edition. Translated by Lewis White Beck. Upper Saddle River, N.J.: Prentice Hall.
Kent, Bonnie. “Augustine’s Ethics.” 2001. In The Cambridge Companion to Augustine. Edited by Eleonore Stump and Norman Kretzmann. New York: Cambridge University Press: 205-233.
Kierkegaard, Søren. 1985. Fear and Trembling. Translated by Alastair Hannay. New York: Penguin.
Kretzmann, Norman. 1983. “Abraham, Isaac, and Euthyphro: God and the Basis of Morality.” In Hamarti, The Concept of Error in the Western Tradition: Essays in Honor of John M. Crossett. Edited by D.V. Stump, E. Stump, J.A. Arieti, and L. Gerson. New York: Edwin Mellen Press.
Leibniz, Gottfried Wilhelm. 1951. Theodicy. London: Routledge, Kegan, and Paul.
Mackie, J. L. 1977. Ethics: Inventing Right and Wrong. New York: Penguin Books.
Moreland, J. P. and Kai Nielsen. 1990. Does God Exist?: The Great Debate. Nashville: Thomas Nelson.
Morris, Thomas V. 1987. “Duty and Divine Goodness.” American Philosophical Quarterly 21.
Morris, Thomas V. 1991. Our Idea of God: An Introduction to Philosophical Theology. Notre Dame, Ind.: University of Notre Dame Press.
Morriston, Wes. 2001. “Must There Be a Standard of Moral Goodness Apart from God?” Philosophia Christi Series 2, 3: 127-138.
Murphy, Mark. “Divine Command, Divine Will, and Moral Obligation.” Faith and Philosophy 15 (1998): 3-27.
Nielsen, Kai. 1973. Ethics Without God. Buffalo, N.Y.: Prometheus Books.
Nuyen, R. T. 1998. “Is Kant a Divine Command Theorist?” History of Philosophy Quarterly 15: 441-453.
Plato. 1981. Five Dialogues: Euthyphro, Apology, Crito, Meno, Phaedo. Translated by G. M. A. Grube. Indianapolis, Ind.: Hackett Publishing Company.
Quinn, Philip L. 1978. Divine Commands and Moral Requirements. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
Quinn, Philip L. 1979. “Divine Command Ethics: A Causal Theory.” In Divine Command Morality: Historical and Contemporary Readings. Edited by Janine Idziak. New York: Edwin Mellen Press, 1979: 305-325.
Quinn, Philip. 1992. “The Primacy of God’s Will in Christian Ethics.” Philosophical Perspectives 6: 493-513.
Stump, Eleonore, and Norman Kretzmann. 1985. “Absolute Simplicity.” Faith and Philosophy 2: 353-382.
Stump, Eleonore. 2001. “Evil and the Nature of Faith.” In Seeking Understanding: The Stob Lectures 1986-1998. Grand Rapids, Mich.: Eerdmans: 530-550.
Thomas Aquinas, Saint. 1947. The Summa Theologica. Translated by the Fathers of the English Dominican Province.
Wainright, William J. 2005. Religion and Morality. Burlington, Verm.: Ashgate.
Wierenga, Edward. 1983. “A Defensible Divine Command Theory.” Nous 17, pp. 387-407.
Wierenga, Edward. 1989. The Nature of God: An Inquiry into Divine Attributes. Ithaca, N.Y.: Cornell University Press.
William of Ockham. Super 4 Libros Sententiarum II, 19.
Zagzebski, Linda. 2004. Divine Motivation Theory. New York: Cambridge University Press.

Author Information

Michael W. Austin
Email: mike.austin@eku.edu
Eastern Kentucky University
U. S. A.

Contextualism in Epistemology

In very general terms, epistemological contextualism maintains that whether one knows is somehow relative to context. Certain features of contexts—features such as the intentions and presuppositions of the members of a conversational context—shape the standards that one must meet in order for one’s beliefs to count as knowledge. This allows for the possibility that different contexts set different epistemic standards, and contextualists invariably maintain that the standards do in fact vary from context to context. In some contexts, the epistemic standards are unusually high, and it is difficult, if not impossible, for our beliefs to count as knowledge in such contexts. In most contexts, however, the epistemic standards are comparatively low, and our beliefs can and often do count as knowledge in these contexts. The primary arguments for epistemological contextualism claim that contextualism best explains our epistemic judgments—it explains why we judge in most contexts that we have knowledge and why we judge in some contexts that we don’t—and that contextualism provides the best solution to puzzles generated by skeptical arguments.

Introduction
Subjunctive Conditionals Contextualism
Relevant Alternatives Contextualism and Rejecting Closure
1. Dretske’s Relevant Alternatives Theory of Knowledge
2. Relevant Alternatives Contextualisms that Reject Closure
Relevant Alternatives Contextualism and Accepting Closure
Contextualism and Epistemic Rationality
Other Forms of Epistemological Contextualism
Objections to Contextualism
Alternatives to Contextualism
Conclusion
References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

Epistemological contextualism has evolved primarily as a response to views that maintain that we have no knowledge of the world around us. Taking quite seriously the problems presented by skepticism, contextualists seek to resolve the apparent conflict between claims like the following:

I know that I have hands.
But I don’t know that I have hands if I don’t know that I’m not a brain-in-a-vat (that is, a bodiless brain that is floating in a vat of nutrients and that is electrochemically stimulated in a way that generates perceptual experiences that are exactly similar to those that I am now having in what I take to be normal circumstances).
I don’t know that I’m not a brain-in-a-vat (henceforth, a BIV).

These claims, when taken together, present a puzzle. (1), (2), and (3) are independently plausible yet mutually inconsistent. That (1) is plausible seems to require no explanation. (3) is plausible because it seems that in order to know that I’m not a BIV, I must rule out the possibility that I am a BIV. Yet the BIV and I have perceptual experiences that are exactly similar—it seems to the BIV, just as it seems to me, that he has hands, that he is sitting at his desk and in front of his computer, and so on. Accordingly, my perceptual experiences give me no reason to favor the belief that I am not a BIV over the belief that I am. Thus, since I have only my perceptual experiences to go on, I cannot rule out the possibility that I’m a BIV. Considerations like these contribute to (3)’s plausibility.

Moreover, it seems that I can’t know that I have hands—and, in general, that I can’t know that I have any body at all —if I can’t rule out the possibility that I’m a bodiless BIV. This, then, contributes to the plausibility of (2). It seems in addition that (2) always retains its plausibility, no matter how high or low we set the standards for knowledge. Keith DeRose (1999a) defends this claim by noting that it is always a comparative fact that my epistemic position with respect to the claim that I’m not a BIV is just as strong as my epistemic position with respect to the claim that I have hands. If this is correct, then (2) is true across contexts, no matter what the epistemic standards.

Yet in spite of the fact that they are independently plausible, (1), (2), and (3) are mutually inconsistent; they cannot all be true. It seems, therefore, that we must give up one of these claims. But which one should we give up, and why?

In trying to answer these questions, contextualists maintain that ‘know’ either is or functions very much like an indexical, that is, an expression whose semantic content (or meaning) depends on the context of its use. For example, the word ‘here’ is an indexical. I say, “Jaime is here,” and what I mean depends on where I am when I say it. If I’m in the conference room, then I mean, all other things being equal, that Jaime is in the conference room. ‘I’ is also an indexical—its meaning depends on the context of its use and, in particular, on who is using it. When Jaime says, “I am in the conference room,” then he means, all other things being equal, that Jaime is in the conference room. Yet when Julie uses ‘I’, she means something different; Julie’s ‘I’ means Julie.

If ‘know’ is an indexical, its semantic content (or meaning) will depend on the context in which it is used. Furthermore, since context will affect the semantic content of ‘know’, context will have an effect on the semantic content of complex lexical items in which ‘know’ appears, for example, on the semantic content of knowledge attributions like ‘Jaime knows that he’s in the conference room’. Contextualists have put the point this way:

the truth-conditions of knowledge ascribing and knowledge denying sentences (sentences of the form ‘S knows that P’ and ‘S doesn’t know that P’ and related variants of such sentences) vary in certain ways according to the contexts in which they are uttered. What so varies is the epistemic standards that S must meet (or, in the case of a denial of knowledge, fail to meet) in order for such a statement to be true. (DeRose 1999a, p. 187)

Given this, contextualists maintain that (1), (2), and (3) do not in fact conflict, even though it seems that they do. They suggest, first of all, that some contexts set very high epistemic standards, standards according to which knowledge requires a great deal. Contexts in which these high standards are in play are typically those in which we are considering and taking seriously certain skeptical hypotheses. For example, in order to know anything at all about the world around us, these high standards might require us to rule out the possibility that we are BIVs, or the possibility that we are now dreaming, or the possibility that we are now being deceived by an omnipotent but malevolent demon. Yet our perceptual experiences afford us no evidence that would allow us to rule out these skeptical possibilities, for if we were BIVs, for example, we would be having exactly the same perceptual experiences that we’re now having. Thus, we fail to meet these high epistemic standards with respect both to the belief that I have hands and to the belief that I’m not a BIV. (1) is therefore false in these high-standards contexts while (3) is true. According to contextualists, then, we should reject (1) in high-standards contexts. When we do so, we are no longer faced with a conflict, for the conflict presents itself only when we insist on the truth of each of the three mutually inconsistent claims. Moreover, in rejecting (1) in high-standards contexts, contextualism gives the skeptic his due, and takes seriously the compelling nature of skeptical arguments.

Nevertheless, contextualists maintain that in most contexts, the epistemic standards are comparatively low. Typically, these are ordinary contexts in which we are considering no skeptical hypotheses. In such contexts, we can have knowledge of the world around us without eliminating skeptical possibilities like the BIV possibility. In order to know that I have a hand, for example, I need eliminate only possibilities like those in which I have no hands, or in which I have paws or claws instead of hands. Moreover, the evidence provided by my perceptual experiences—the evidence that I obtain by looking at my hands, or by hearing the sounds made when I clap them together—does allow me to eliminate these possibilities. Thus, we can meet the epistemic standards that are in place in low-standards contexts. (1) is therefore true in these contexts while (3) is false. According to contextualists, then, we should reject (3) in low-standards contexts. And here again, in rejecting (3), we keep the conflict between (1), (2), and (3) from presenting itself. Moreover, in rejecting (3) in low-standards contexts, contextualism allows us to retain our ordinary knowledge—it allows us to know the things we ordinarily take ourselves to know.

Yet if we are never actually faced with a conflict between (1), (2), and (3), why does it seem as if we are? Contextualists respond in this way: Since we most often find ourselves in low-standards contexts, we tend to evaluate knowledge attributions according to the epistemic standards that are in place in those contexts. Thus, we tend to reckon (1) true. However, since (3) makes explicit reference to BIVs, our evaluation of that claim tends to lead us to entertain the BIV skeptical scenario. Doing this can raise the epistemic standards—it can push us into a context in which the epistemic standards are quite high—and so we tend to reckon (3) true. And so it seems that we are faced with a conflict between (1), (2), and (3). Yet it merely seems as if we are faced with such a conflict. For, as we have seen, when the epistemic standards are high, (1) is false while (3) is true. But when the standards are lower, (1) is true while (3) is false.

Contextualism also allows us to explain why it seems in certain contexts that we don’t know that we have hands (for example). We make these epistemic judgments at least partly because it’s true in such contexts that we don’t know that we have hands. And we judge in other contexts that we know that we have hands at least partly because such claims are true in those other contexts. Thus, contextualism not only helps us to see our way out of apparent conflicts like those between (1), (2), and (3), but it also helps us to explain why we make the epistemic judgments that we do.

The most prominent forms of epistemological contextualism are based either on Robert Nozick’s subjunctive conditionals account of knowledge or on the relevant alternatives theory of knowledge that is associated with Fred Dretske and Alvin Goldman. The primary difference between these two forms of contextualism is in how they characterize epistemic standards. As we will see, the former characterizes the standards in terms of subjunctive conditionals, while the latter characterizes them in terms of relevant alternatives. We will consider subjunctive conditionals contextualism in Section 2 and relevant alternatives contextualism in Sections 3 and 4. Some forms of contextualism, however, are based on neither of these theories. One such view is the version of contextualism that Stewart Cohen advocates most recently, and we will consider this view in Section 5. Let us turn now, though, to subjunctive conditionals contextualism.

2. Subjunctive Conditionals Contextualism

Keith DeRose provides an influential brand of epistemological contextualism. It is intended to solve the puzzles generated by groups of statements like the following:

I know that I have hands.
But I don’t know that I have hands if I don’t know that I’m not a BIV.
I don’t know that I’m not a BIV.

DeRose claims that in contexts in which the standards for knowledge are unusually high, we should reject (1) and that the skeptic can truthfully say in such contexts that I don’t know that I have hands. In other contexts, however, the epistemic standards are more relaxed and we can both reject (3) and correctly say that I do know that I have hands.

DeRose’s contextualist solution seeks to explain the plausibility of (3) by utilizing resources provided by Robert Nozick. Specifically, DeRose’s solution appeals to the Subjunctive Conditionals Account (SCA) of the plausibility of (3). According to SCA, “we have a very strong general, though not exceptionless, inclination to think that we don’t know that P when we think that our belief that P is a belief we would hold even if P were false” (DeRose 1999a, p. 193). DeRose calls the belief that P insensitive if it is one that we would hold even if P were false. SCA’s generalization thus becomes: We are inclined to think that S doesn’t know that P if we think that S’s belief that P is insensitive.

DeRose claims that even though this generalization does not represent our ordinary standard for knowledge, there are contexts in which the skeptic puts it into place as the standard (for example, by mentioning skeptical possibilities like the possibility that you are now a BIV). The standard in such contexts is the skeptical standard, according to which my beliefs must be sensitive if they are to count as knowledge. When this standard is in place, as it is in skeptical contexts, I fail to know that I’m not a BIV. For my belief that I’m not a BIV is not sensitive: I would believe that I wasn’t a BIV even if I were a BIV. Moreover, since (2) is true in all contexts, it follows that I don’t know in skeptical contexts that I have hands. In this way, DeRose’s contextualism explains the plausibility of (3) and gives the skeptic his due by arguing that there are contexts in which we should reject (1).

But DeRose wants to avoid the boldly skeptical conclusion that I never know that I have hands, and he does this by arguing that in ordinary contexts of knowledge attribution—contexts in which the skeptical standard is not in place and in which the epistemic standards are comparatively low—we can reject (3). In these contexts, the skeptical standard is not in place, and our beliefs need not be sensitive in order to count as knowledge. Thus, we can truthfully assert in ordinary contexts that I do know that I have hands. And, since (2) is true in all contexts, it follows that I know in ordinary contexts that I’m not a BIV. In this way, DeRose’s contextualism explains the plausibility of rejecting (3) and allows us to retain the knowledge that we ordinarily take ourselves to have.

According to DeRose, the relevant difference between these contexts is that the standards for knowledge are quite high in skeptical contexts but comparatively low in ordinary ones. But what accounts for this difference? DeRose recognizes that he must “explain how the standards for knowledge are raised [by the skeptic]” (DeRose 1999a, p. 206) if his solution is to be adequate. Essential to this explanation is DeRose’s Rule of Sensitivity:

When someone asserts that S knows (or does not know) that P, the standards for knowledge tend to be raised, if need be, to a level such that S’s belief that P must be sensitive if it is to count as knowledge. (DeRose 1999a, p. 206)

He then provides the following explanation of how the skeptic raises the standards.

In utilizing [puzzles like those generated by (1)-(3)] to attack our putative knowledge of O [where O is a proposition that we ordinarily take ourselves to know], the skeptic instinctively chooses her skeptical hypothesis, H, so that it will have these two features: (1) We will be in at least as strong a position to know that not-H as we’re in to know that O, but (2) Any belief we might have to the effect that not-H will be an insensitive belief…. Given feature (2), the skeptic’s assertion that we don’t know that not-H, by the Rule of Sensitivity, drives the standards for knowledge up to such a point as to make that assertion true. …And since we’re in no stronger an epistemic position with respect to O than we’re in with respect to not-H (feature (1)), then, at the high standards put in place by the skeptic’s assertion of [(3)], we also fail to know that O. (DeRose 1999a, pp. 206-7)

DeRose maintains, then, that the skeptic’s assertion is the mechanism she uses to raise the standards for knowledge. When the skeptic asserts that I don’t know that I’m not a BIV, the Rule of Sensitivity is invoked, and the standards for knowledge are raised to such a level that my beliefs must be sensitive if they are to count as knowledge. And since my belief that I’m not a BIV is not sensitive—that is, since I would believe that I wasn’t a BIV even if I were a BIV—I do not know in skeptical contexts that I’m not a BIV. Thus, given the truth of (2), I do not know in skeptical contexts that I have hands (or, for that matter, anything that I ordinarily take myself to know.)

Nevertheless, when no one mentions a skeptical hypothesis, the Rule of Sensitivity is not invoked, and the epistemic standards allow beliefs to count as knowledge even though they are not sensitive. This means that in ordinary contexts, we are still in a position to know the things we ordinarily take ourselves to know.

3. Relevant Alternatives Contextualism and Rejecting Closure

Perhaps the main motivation for epistemological contextualism is now the relevant alternatives theory of knowledge. There are two kinds of relevant alternatives contextualism. One kind rejects the closure principle, according to which knowledge is closed under known implication:

If S knows that p, and knows that p implies q, then S knows that q.

The closure principle is both plausible and explanatorily valuable. For one thing, it helps to explain how we come to know things via deduction. I know, for example, that tomorrow is Saturday. I know this because I know that today is Friday and that if today is Friday then tomorrow is Saturday. The closure principle helps to account for this knowledge, and the fact that I come to know things via deduction—and in accordance with the closure principle—renders that principle both plausible and desirable.

A second kind of relevant alternatives contextualism accepts the closure principle.

In Section 3.2, we will consider Mark Heller’s relevant alternatives contextualism, which represents accounts that reject the closure principle. Before examining Heller’s contextualism, however, we should consider the theory that motivates it.

a. Dretske’s Relevant Alternatives Theory of Knowledge

Fred Dretske proposes “to think of knowledge as an evidential state in which all relevant alternatives (to what is known) are eliminated” (Dretske 2000b, p. 52). This is the relevant alternatives theory of knowledge, or RA. But this leaves several questions unanswered.

First, what is an alternative to p? A proposition q is an alternative to p if and only if it cannot be true both that q and that p. Thus, the proposition that this animal is a Siberian grebe is an alternative to the proposition that it’s a Gadwall duck. For the animal cannot be both a Siberian grebe and a Gadwall duck.

Second, what is a relevant alternative to p? Dretske says that a relevant alternative is an alternative “that a person must be in a[n] evidential position to exclude (when he knows that P)” (Dretske 2000b, p. 57). But this doesn’t help very much at all. What is it about the alternatives that S must exclude that makes them such that she must exclude them? Unfortunately, there is no widely accepted response to this question. The vote seems to be split between two candidates. Some, including Dretske, say that an alternative q is relevant only if there is an objective possibility that q. But others say that q can be a relevant alternative simply because we regard q as a possibility.

Third, what does it mean to eliminate a relevant alternative? Here, too, there is disagreement. One view about elimination is the strongest view, according to which S can eliminate a relevant alternative q only if her evidence for believing not-q is strong enough to allow her to know that not-q. A proponent of RA might instead adopt the strong view, according to which S can eliminate q if her evidence for thinking that not-q is either strong enough to allow her to know that not-q or strong enough to allow her to have very good reason to believe that not-q. A proponent of RA might also adopt the weak view, according to which S can eliminate a relevant alternative q by meeting one of the following three conditions: (i) her evidence for not-q is strong enough to allow her to know that not-q, (ii) her evidence for not-q is strong enough to allow her to have very good reason to believe that not-q, or (iii) S’s belief that not-q is epistemically non-evidentially rational, where this is “a way in which it can be rational (or reasonable) [for S] to believe [that not-q] without possessing evidence for the belief” (Cohen 1988, p. 112). Some RA contextualists make it clear that they have something like the weak view in mind (see Cohen 1988 and Stine 1976), but most fail to make it clear which of the three views they adopt.

Dretske argues that I can know that p without eliminating the irrelevant alternatives to p. Still, he maintains that my knowing that p entails nothing whatsoever about whether I know that q, where q is an irrelevant alternative to p and might even be a necessary consequence of p. This amounts to a denial of the closure principle. Suppose that the alternative that this is a Siberian grebe is irrelevant to my knowing that it is a Gadwall duck. Notice too that the negation of the former proposition is a necessary consequence of the latter proposition—if this is a Gadwall duck, then it is not a Siberian grebe. Dretske claims that I can know that this is a Gadwall duck even though I don’t know that it’s not a Siberian grebe. Thus, Dretske holds that the closure principle is false.

This verdict is quite controversial, however, and there is disagreement over this matter even among proponents of RA. I see the lines of this disagreement as boundaries between different kinds of RA theories, and we can classify RA theories according to whether they accept or reject closure. We might choose to do this partly because RA contextualists, as well as RA theorists in general, tend to make it clear whether they accept closure, while they do not always make it clear where they stand on other issues (e.g., on the issue of relevance and on the issue of elimination). Primarily, though, we should distinguish between RA contextualists who accept closure and those who reject it because their views about closure crucially influence how they respond to skepticism. As we shall shortly see, those who reject closure deny one of the conflicting claims, namely, (2), the claim that I don’t know that I have hands if I don’t know that I’m not a BIV. So, according to RA contextualists who reject closure, there really is no conflict at all between claims (1) and (3). But according to those who accept closure, there is such a conflict. For, by the closure principle, in contexts in which I don’t know that certain skeptical alternatives do not obtain, I also fail to know certain things about the external world.

In Section 4, we will see how RA contextualists who accept closure respond to skepticism. In the following section, however, we will examine the response provided by RA contextualists who reject closure.

b. Relevant Alternatives Contextualisms that Reject Closure

Consider the puzzle that is generated by the following argument:

I don’t know that I’m not a BIV in a treeless world (that is, a BIVT).
If I know that there is a tree before me (call the italicized proposition T), and I know that T implies my not being a BIVT, then I know that I’m not a BIVT.
So, I don’t know that T (given that I know that T implies my not being a BIVT).

In “Relevant Alternatives and Closure,” Mark Heller follows Dretske’s lead and argues that we can solve this skeptical puzzle by rejecting the closure principle, of which (5) is an instance.

To show why we should give up (5) (and hence the closure principle), Heller argues for a particular interpretation of RA. He claims that (5) is false if his interpretation of RA is true. He calls his interpretation Expanded Relevant Alternatives, or ERA.

(ERA) S knows that p only if S does not believe p in any of the closest not-p worlds or any more distant not-p worlds that are still close enough.

ERA accounts for our inclination to think, for example, that if I know that T, I will not believe that T in any of the closest worlds in which it’s not the case that T. In addition, ERA accounts for our inclination to think that something else is sometimes needed if I am to know that T. Imagine that “the actual world is cluttered with papier mâché tree facsimiles which S is unable to distinguish from real trees” (Heller 1999b, p. 200). In this case, we are inclined to say that S doesn’t know that T even if she doesn’t believe that T in any of the closest not-T worlds. Here, even though worlds that are cluttered with papier mâché tree facsimiles are not among the closest not-T worlds, they are close enough to the actual world to count as relevant. So Heller claims that in at least some cases, if S is to know that p, she must not believe that p in any of the close enough not-p worlds.

ERA provides the foundation for a relevant alternatives contextualism, for it allows us to see different contexts as setting different epistemic standards. Which not-p worlds count as epistemically relevant—that is, which not-p worlds count as being close enough to the actual world—will vary from context to context. And since ERA characterizes epistemic standards in terms of relevant alternatives (that is, in terms of relevant not-p worlds), it allows for the context-sensitivity of epistemic standards.

In light of this, Heller maintains, we may solve the skeptical puzzle by concluding that (5) is false. Note first of all that there are no contexts in which I know that I’m not a BIVT. Given ERA, if I am to know that I’m not a BIVT, I must not believe that I’m not a BIVT in any of the closest BIVT worlds. Thus, since I do believe that I’m not a BIVT in the closest BIVT worlds, I don’t know that I’m not a BIVT.

Nevertheless, there are contexts in which I do know that T. This is true because we use “different worlds as relevant alternatives when considering whether [I know that T] from those used when considering whether [I know that I’m not a BIVT]” (Heller 1999b, p. 197). According to ERA, I know in C that T because I don’t believe that T in any of the not-T worlds that are close enough to the actual world. (And we need consider only the close enough not-T worlds because those worlds include the closest not-T worlds.) So given that ERA is true, (5) is false: I can know that there is a tree before me (and hence evade the skeptic’s snare) even though I don’t know that I’m not a BIVT. We can therefore solve the skeptical puzzle by giving up the closure principle.

Any solution to the skeptical puzzle that denies the truth of (5) must explain why it seems to us that (5) is true. In providing this explanation, Heller argues that (5) seems true because some contexts conform to the demands of the closure principle. For example, there are contexts in which astonishingly distant not-T worlds—for example, worlds in which I am a BIVT—are close enough to the actual world to count as epistemically relevant. In those contexts, I know neither that T nor that I’m not a BIVT. For, in BIVT worlds, I believe both that T and that I’m not a BIVT. The fact that there are contexts such as these, contexts that conform to the demands of the closure principle, can make it seem that (5) is true.

4. Relevant Alternatives Contextualism and Accepting Closure

Some relevant alternatives contextualisms accept the closure principle. In this section, we will examine the contextualist theory espoused by Stewart Cohen in his influential article “How to be a Fallibilist.” Cohen’s theory is perhaps the most prominent relevant alternatives contextualism and should be counted among the most notable of all contextualisms.

Cohen’s contextualism, like others, is intended to solve certain skeptical puzzles. The puzzle with which Cohen is concerned is familiar—it consists of three independently plausible but mutually inconsistent propositions.

I know that I have hands.
If I don’t know that I’m not a BIV, then I don’t know that I have hands.
I don’t know that I’m not a BIV.

To solve this paradox, Cohen relies on a relevant alternatives contextualism, one that accepts the plausibility—and indeed the truth—of proposition (2), which follows from the closure principle (given that I know that my having hands implies my not being a BIV). Cohen claims that in skeptical contexts, contexts in which the BIV alternative is relevant, we should accept propositions (2) and (3) but deny proposition (1). However, in ordinary contexts, contexts in which the BIV alternative is not relevant, we should accept (1) and (2) but deny (3).

Let’s look at the details of Cohen’s account. For Cohen,

an alternative (to [some proposition] q) h is relevant (for [some person] S) = df S’s epistemic position with respect to h precludes S from knowing q. (Cohen 1988, p. 101)

Cohen also claims that there are criteria of relevance and that these criteria ought to reflect our intuitions about the conditions under which S knows that q. He says that our intuitions are influenced both by conditions that are internal and by conditions that are external to a person’s evidence. Accordingly, he offers two criteria of relevance. First, there is the external criterion.

An alternative (to p) h is relevant if the probability of h conditional on reason r and certain features of the circumstances is sufficiently high (where the level of probability that is sufficient is determined by context). (Cohen 1988, p. 102)

By this criterion, the fact that there are a number of cleverly painted mules in the zoo, whether or not I have any evidence for this fact, can be sufficient to make relevant the alternative that this is a cleverly painted mule. Presumably, if there are a number of cleverly painted mules in the zoo, it is probable to some determinate degree d that this is a cleverly painted mule rather than, say, a zebra. And according to Cohen, the context determines, for example, that probabilities of degree d* and higher are sufficiently high to render an alternative relevant. Thus, according to the external criterion, if d is greater than or equal to d*, the alternative that this is a cleverly painted mule will be relevant in this context.

Second, there is the internal criterion.

An alternative (to q) h is relevant if S lacks sufficient evidence (reason) to deny h, i.e., to believe not-h (Cohen 1988, p. 103),

where the amount of evidence that is sufficient is presumably determined by context. By this criterion, the amount of evidence that S has for her belief that this is not a cleverly painted mule can be sufficiently low to make relevant the alternative that it is a cleverly painted mule. We may again presume that S has a determinate amount of evidence a for her belief that this is not a cleverly painted mule. Here, the context determines, say, that amounts of evidence a* and lower are sufficiently low to render an alternative relevant. So if a is less than or equal to a*, the alternative that this is a cleverly painted mule will be relevant in this context.

Both the internal criterion and the external criterion are sensitive to context. According to Cohen, then,

there will be no general specification of what constitutes sufficient evidence to deny an alternative in order for it not to be relevant, and as such, no general specification of what constitutes sufficient evidence to know q. Rather, this will depend on the context in which the attribution of knowledge occurs. (Cohen 1988, p. 103)

But how do the standards of relevance shift? Cohen recognizes that he must explain how this shift occurs if his contextualist solution to the skeptical paradox is to work. Because Cohen thinks of reasons as statistical in nature, he thinks that they advertise both the chance that we believe correctly on their basis and the chance that we believe erroneously on their basis. When the chances for error are highlighted, those chances become salient, and the standards for relevance shift. Thus, highlighting the chances for error allows certain alternatives to become relevant.

For example, suppose that I have reasons to believe that this is a zebra. It looks for all the world like a zebra; it is in an area of the zoo that is clearly marked “zebras”; I believe with good reason that zookeepers put only zebras in areas marked “zebras”; and so on. But perhaps someone underscores the fact that all of these reasons are compatible with this animal’s being a cleverly painted mule. Such mules look for all the world like zebras, and in a pinch even the most conscientious zookeeper might put such creatures in an area marked “zebras.” Underscoring these facts makes salient the chance that I believe erroneously on the basis of my reasons, and it makes relevant the alternative that this is a cleverly painted mule.

This suggests that, for Cohen, the standards of relevance shift whenever someone underscores the statistical nature of our reasons, whenever someone points out that there is a chance that we believe erroneously on the basis of those reasons. So, in ordinary contexts, contexts in which no one underscores the chance that I believe erroneously, that chance will not be salient, and I can know on the basis of my reasons that this is a zebra. However, in skeptical contexts, contexts in which someone does underscore the chance that I believe erroneously, that chance will be salient. In these contexts, my attention will have been focused on the chance that I am wrong, and the alternative that this is a cleverly painted mule will be relevant. Since I cannot eliminate that alternative, I do not know that this is a zebra.

Cohen suggests that his relevant alternatives contextualism allows us to solve skeptical puzzles like those that focus on zebras and cleverly painted mules. This is because his version of the relevant alternatives theory is formulated in terms of evidence, and such puzzles involve beliefs for which we can have evidence. But Cohen suggests that radical skeptical paradoxes involve beliefs for which we can have no evidence—”radical skeptical hypotheses are immune to rejection on the basis of any evidence” (Cohen 1988, p. 111). As it is, then, Cohen’s relevant alternatives contextualism seems ill equipped to resolve radical skeptical paradoxes.

To overcome this difficulty, Cohen adjusts his version of the relevant alternatives theory so that it takes into account beliefs for which I can have no evidence. He claims that for some such beliefs it is epistemically rational for me to hold them even though I possess no evidence for them. He calls beliefs of this sort intrinsically rational beliefs. Among the intrinsically rational beliefs is my belief that I’m not a BIV. According to Cohen, it is rational for me to believe that I’m not a BIV even though I have no evidence for that belief.

Taking into account intrinsically rational beliefs, Cohen amends the internal criterion of relevance. First, he says that

it is reasonable for a subject S to believe a proposition q just in case S possesses sufficient evidence in support of q, or q is intrinsically rational. (Cohen 1988, p. 113)

He then provides the following amended version of the internal criterion, or ICa:

(ICa:) An alternative (to p) h is relevant if it is not sufficiently reasonable for S to deny h (to believe not-h), where, presumably, the degree of reasonableness that is sufficient is determined by context.

Cohen now notes that according to ICa: the alternative that I am a BIV is not ordinarily relevant. For my belief that I’m not a BIV is intrinsically rational. This means that the alternative that I am a BIV does not preclude me from knowing, on the basis of my reasons, that I have hands. Thus, I can know in ordinary contexts that I have hands (given both that my reasons are sufficient for my knowing that I have hands and that all relevant alternatives are eliminated). Furthermore, Cohen claims that since the standards are comparatively low in ordinary contexts, I can also know in those contexts that I’m not a BIV.

However, there are contexts in which the skeptic underscores the fact that I can have no evidence for my belief that I’m not a BIV. By doing this, the skeptic focuses my attention on the chance of error. According to Cohen, this makes relevant the alternative that I am a BIV, and I cannot eliminate that alternative. So, by the standards that apply in these skeptical contexts, I know neither that I’m not a BIV nor that I have hands. In this way, then, Cohen solves the radical skeptical puzzle while maintaining that closure holds.

5. Contextualism and Epistemic Rationality

Certain objections have led Cohen to abandon the relevant alternatives contextualism that he presents in “How to be a Fallibilist” and to revise his contextualist solution to radical skeptical paradoxes. He is most troubled by two objections. First, he is troubled by the idea that I can have evidence for my belief that I’m not a BIV. Second, he is troubled by the idea that his account commits him to the view that I can have a priori knowledge of some contingent facts, in particular, of the fact that I’m not a BIV. On the view that he presents in “How to be a Fallibilist,” I can know that I’m not a BIV solely on the basis of the intrinsic rationality of denying that I am a BIV. According to Cohen (see Cohen 1999, p. 69), this means that I can know a priori that I’m not a BIV and hence that I can have a priori knowledge of some contingent facts. These two objections have led Cohen away from his earlier relevant alternatives contextualism.

Even though Cohen now admits that I can have evidence for my belief that I’m not a BIV, he still thinks that there are beliefs for which I can never have evidence. He formulates a new radical skeptical paradox in terms of such beliefs. Cohen asks us to imagine a creature that is a BIV but will never have evidence that it is. Call such a creature a BIV*. Now, my belief that I’m not a BIV* is a belief for which I will never have evidence. We can formulate the following new paradox in terms of that belief.

I know that I have hands.

f I don’t know that I’m not a BIV*, then I don’t know that I have hands.
I don’t know that I’m not a BIV*.

Since this paradox involves a skeptical hypothesis for which I can never have evidence, the idea that I can have evidence for my belief that I’m not a BIV* should not trouble Cohen’s solution to this new paradox.

But given that Cohen has abandoned the relevant alternatives framework, just what is his solution to the BIV* paradox? He notes first of all that my belief that I’m not a BIV* can be intrinsically rational, or what he now calls non-evidentially rational. Once again, S’s belief that p is non-evidentially rational if it is epistemically rational for S to believe that p even though S has no evidence for that belief. Furthermore, Cohen now suggests that

S knows that p if and only if her belief that p is epistemically rational to some degree d, where epistemic rationality has both an evidential and a non-evidential component, and where d is determined by context. (see Cohen 1999, pp. 63-69, 76-77)

Suppose, then, that I have a certain amount of evidence for my belief that I have hands, and that my belief that I have hands is therefore evidentially rational to degree de:. Suppose too that my belief that I’m not a BIV* is non-evidentially rational to some degree dne. Cohen claims that “the non-evidential rationality [of my belief that I’m not a BIV*] is a component of the overall rationality or justification for any empirical proposition” (Cohen 1999, p. 86, fn. 36). So we may suppose that my belief that I have hands is epistemically rational to degree d*, where d* equals de plus dne.

Cohen now says that the degree to which a belief must be epistemically rational if it is to count as knowledge is “determined by some complicated function of speaker intentions, listener expectations, presuppositions of the conversation, salience relations, etc.” (Cohen 1999, p. 61). He suggests that the listeners’ cooperation is an essential part of this function. He also claims that in ordinary contexts this complicated function specifies that a belief is sufficiently epistemically rational if it is epistemically rational to degree do. And d*—the degree to which my belief that I have hands is epistemically rational—is greater than do. This means that I can know in ordinary contexts that I have hands. “And since my having a hand entails my not being a brain-in-a-vat [and a fortiori a BIV*], in those same [ordinary] contexts, my belief that I am not a brain-in-a-vat is sufficiently rational for me to know I am not a brain-in-a-vat” (Cohen 1999, p. 77). This allows him to overcome the objection that I know a priori that I’m not a BIV, for “my knowledge that I am not a brain-in-a-vat is based, in part, on my empirical evidence (the evidence that I have a hand), and so is not a priori” (Cohen 1999, p. 76). In ordinary contexts, then, we accept propositions (1) and (7) of the new radical skeptical paradox, but deny proposition (8).

But in skeptical contexts the complicated function specifies that a belief is sufficiently epistemically rational only if it is epistemically rational to degree ds. And d* is less than Ds This means that in skeptical contexts “my belief that I have a hand is not sufficiently rational for me to know I have a hand. In those same [skeptical] contexts, I have no basis for knowing I am not a brain-in-a-vat” (Cohen 1999, p. 77). In skeptical contexts, we accept propositions (7) and (8) but deny proposition (1). In this way, then, Cohen solves the BIV* paradox while maintaining that closure holds.

6. Other Forms of Epistemological Contextualism

Besides those already discussed, a few other forms of epistemological contextualism warrant mention. We begin with the form that belongs to Steven Rieber, which is most similar to those already considered.

a. Explanatory Contextualism

In “Skepticism and Contrastive Explanation,” Steven Rieber provides a contextualist solution to the skeptical puzzle generated when (1), (2), and (3) are considered together. He first proposes the following analysis of knowledge:

S knows that P … iff: the fact that P explains why S believes that P. (Rieber 1998, p. 194)

He next claims that his analysis of knowledge “generates the sort of context-sensitivity needed to solve the skeptical puzzle” (Rieber 1998, p. 195). He says that “what counts as an explanation is highly context-dependent. In particular, as recent work on contrastive explanation has made clear, it can depend on an implied contrast” (Rieber 1998, p. 195). For example, only those who have syphilis contract paresis, but most of those who have syphilis never get paresis. Suppose that Smith has both syphilis and paresis. We might ask

(S) Does the fact that Smith has syphilis explain why he contracted paresis?

According to Rieber, the answer to this question can depend on what is being implicitly contrasted with Smith. If there is an implied contrast with Jones, who has neither syphilis nor paresis, then we understand (S) to be asking

(J) Does the fact that Smith has syphilis explain why he rather than Jones contracted paresis?

And the answer to (J) might well be yes. However, if there is an implied contrast with Brown, who has syphilis but did not contract paresis, then we understand (S) to be asking

(B) Does the fact that Smith has syphilis explain why he rather than Brown contracted paresis?

And the answer to (B) might well be no. So it seems that whether one thing explains another can depend on context. Thus, given Rieber’s explanatory analysis of knowledge, knowledge too will be context-sensitive.

Rieber’s analysis of knowledge seems to him to be well suited to solve the skeptical puzzle. He suggests that on his analysis of knowledge, to ask

(9) Do I know that I have hands?

is to ask

(9a) Does the fact that I have hands explain why I believe that I have hands?

Rieber claims that in ordinary contexts the answer to (9a) is clearly yes, and so I know in such contexts that I have hands. Presumably, I also know in those contexts that I’m not a BIV.

But a consideration of the BIV skeptical possibility can make salient a contrast with that possibility. When this contrast is salient, we understand (9) to be asking

(9b) Does the fact that I have hands rather than being a handless BIV explain why I believe that I have hands rather than that I am a handless BIV?

The answer to (9b) is no, for all of the evidence that I have for my belief that I have hands is compatible with my being a handless BIV. And whenever the answer to (9b) is no, so is the answer to (9). Thus, in skeptical contexts, contexts in which a contrast with the BIV possibility is salient, we should accept (3) but deny (1). The skeptic can truthfully say in such contexts that I know neither that I’m not a BIV nor that I have hands.

Rieber’s explanatory contextualism thus solves our skeptical puzzle. In ordinary contexts, we accept (1) and (2) but deny (3). I know in such contexts both that I have hands and that I’m not a BIV. However, when we consider certain skeptical possibilities, certain contrasts become salient. In these contexts, I know neither that I have hands nor that I’m not a BIV.

b. Evidential Contextualism

In “Contextualism and the Problem of the External World,” Ram Neta argues that the standards for knowledge are invariant, and therefore that we should not see the skeptic as being able to raise those standards. We ought instead to understand the skeptic to be restricting what can count as evidence. The skeptic does this, according to Neta, by exploiting the context-sensitivity of our attributions of evidence. When she brings up the BIV skeptical hypothesis, for example, the skeptic restricts what I can truthfully regard as my evidence to just those mental states that are available to me whether or not I am a BIV. That is, she prevents any of my current mental states from counting as evidence for my beliefs about the external world, thereby creating an unbridgeable (in this context, at least) epistemic gap between my evidence and my beliefs. In these contexts, my beliefs fail to meet the epistemic standard and therefore fail to count as knowledge. Still, in contexts in which I am considering no skeptical hypotheses, I can have plenty of evidence for my beliefs about the external world. In such contexts, my beliefs can meet the epistemic standards and can therefore count as knowledge. In this way, Neta’s version of contextualism, like the other versions we’ve considered, is meant to resolve familiar conflicts and to explain why we judge in most contexts that we have knowledge but why we judge in other contexts that we don’t.

c. Contextualism as a Theory of Knowledge

The last two forms of epistemological contextualism, those belonging to Michael Williams and to David Annis, have few similarities with the forms we’ve considered so far.

In his recent work, Williams argues for contextualism, which is, for him, the view that “independently of all [situational, disciplinary and other contextually variable factors], a proposition has no epistemic status whatsoever. There is no fact of the matter as to what kind of justification it either admits of or requires” (Williams 1996a, p. 119). His arguments for contextualism also count as arguments against epistemological realism, which is the view that even independently of contextual factors, there is a fact of the matter as to what kind of justification a belief requires. In particular, epistemological realism maintains the truth of the doctrine of epistemic priority (or DEP). According to DEP, our beliefs about the external world must be justified by sensory experience if they are to amount to knowledge. Williams argues that epistemological realism in general and DEP in particular are “contentious and possibly dispensable theoretical ideas about knowledge and justification” (Williams 1999b, p. 144). He also argues that skepticism depends essentially on these contentious ideas, and that, being theoretical, they are not forced on us by our ordinary ways of epistemic thinking. This suggests that skepticism is unnatural and thus that the burden of proof belongs to the skeptic. Yet since the skeptic cannot carry this burden, we have, according to Williams, no reason to take skepticism seriously.

Annis’ contextualism is meant to be an alternative both to foundationalism and to coherentism. Annis complains that both foundationalism and coherentism ignore the social nature of justification. According to his version of contextualism, then, S is justified in believing that p only if she can meet certain objections that express real doubts. These objections can include, but are not necessarily limited to, those according to which S is not in a position to know that p and those according to which p is false. We might object, for example, that since S is not reliable in situations like this, she is not in a position to know that the book on yonder shelf is brown. Thus, if S is to be justified in believing that the book is brown, she must be able to meet that objection. The justification of S’s belief that p also depends, according to Annis, on who offers certain objections and on the importance of S’s being right about p. It matters, for example, that it is S’s flight instructors, rather than her teasing friends, who object that she is unreliable when it comes to distinguishing the colors of fairly distant objects. A theory of justification that includes contextual parameters like these, Annis argues, fares better than either foundationalism or coherentism, both of which overlook the social nature of justification.

7. Objections to Contextualism

In this section, we will discuss two leading objections to epistemological contextualism. These are by no means the only criticisms that have been leveled against contextualism, but they introduce themes that have motivated additional objections as well as alternatives to contextualism. A discussion of these objections, then, should provide a center of operations for an exploration of objections to contextualism.

Palle Yourgrau (1983) argues that contextualism allows for dialogues such as the following since it claims that the standards for knowledge shift from context to context:

A: Is that a zebra?
B: Yes, it is a zebra.
A: But can you rule out its merely being a cleverly painted mule?
B: No, I can’t.
A: So you admit you didn’t know it was a zebra.
B: No, I did know then that it was a zebra. But after your question, I no longer knew.

This dialogue strikes Yourgrau as absurd, for it seems that nothing changes during the course of the conversation that would account for a change in B’s epistemic state: B is in just as good an epistemic position at the beginning of the conversation as she is at the end of the conversation, and so it seems that if B knows at the beginning, she should also know at the end. This suggests that, contrary to epistemological contextualism, we cannot affect shifts in the standards for knowledge simply by mentioning certain skeptical possibilities.

Contextualists (see DeRose 1992) have replied to this sort of objection by saying that once A introduces a skeptical possibility and thereby raises the standards for knowledge, B can no longer truly say, “I did know then that it was a zebra.” Once the standards for knowledge have been raised, the truth of any attribution of knowledge, including an attribution that is meant to apply only at some time in the past, must be judged according to those higher standards. Once the standards have been raised, B cannot both attribute knowledge to himself in the past and deny knowledge to himself in the present. He should now only deny himself knowledge; once the standards have been raised, neither B’s past self nor his present self knows that this is a zebra.

Stephen Schiffer has leveled a different sort of criticism at epistemological contextualism. Again, contextualism maintains that we attribute knowledge relative to standards that shift from context to context. This is to say, in effect, that when we say that B knows that this is a zebra, we mean that she knows relative to such-and-such an epistemic standard that this is a zebra. Putting this another way, contextualism maintains that our knowledge attributions are implicitly relative. Yet the contextualist’s response to Yourgrau’s objection suggests that B—or anyone else, for that matter—might fail to realize that our knowledge attributions are implicitly relative to an epistemic standard that shifts from context to context. Schiffer argues, however, that it is a general linguistic truth that speakers do realize that certain attributions are implicitly relative. For example, anyone who utters, “It’s raining,” in order to say that it’s raining in London knows full well that she’s asserting that it’s raining in London. Yet, according to Schiffer, when we utter, “B knows that it’s a zebra,” we typically do not take ourselves to be asserting that B knows relative to any standard. All this suggests, Schiffer argues, that the contextualist is wrong to think that our knowledge attributions are implicitly relative, and hence wrong to think that the standards for knowledge can shift from context to context.

8. Alternatives to Contextualism

Objections like these push people away from epistemological contextualism and toward theories that envisage epistemic standards that remain invariant from context to context. Two such theories present themselves as alternatives to contextualism. The first is skepticism, and the second is Mooreanism. Both skeptics and Mooreans maintain that the standards for knowledge do not shift. Yet while the skeptic claims that they are invariantly quite high, the Moorean claims that the standards are invariantly comparatively low.

The skeptic contends not only that there are no contexts in which we know that we’re not BIVs, but also that there are no contexts in which we know that we have hands (see, for example, Unger 1975 and Stone 2000). This response strikes some as implausible, however, since it does not accord with the thought that there are many contexts in which we can and do know things about the world around us.

The Moorean contends that there are never any insurmountable obstacles to our knowing both that we have hands and that we’re not BIVs.

Ernest Sosa’s Moorean response begins with the rejection of Nozick’s idea that knowledge requires sensitivity (see Section 2). He argues instead that knowledge requires safety, according to which S would believe that p only if it were the case that p (see Sosa 1999, p. 142). Moreover, both my belief that I have hands and my belief that I’m not a BIV are safe. Hence, both beliefs can always count as knowledge. Sosa says that

after all, not easily would one believe that [one was not radically deceived] without it being true … . In the actual world, and for quite a distance away from the actual world, up to quite remote possible worlds, our belief that we are not radically deceived matches the fact as to whether we are or are not radically deceived. (Sosa 1999, p. 147)

Yet if I can know across contexts that I’m not a BIV, why is it that it sometimes seems as if I don’t know that I’m not a BIV? Sosa maintains that since we can easily mistake safety for sensitivity, and since the belief that we’re not BIVs is not sensitive, it can sometimes seem to us that our belief that we’re not BIVs is not safe and thus that we don’t know that we’re not BIVs. Nevertheless, this is, according to Sosa, a mere appearance. For, since our belief is safe, we can know across contexts that we’re not BIVs and thus adopt a Moorean response to our skeptical puzzles.

Tim Black also provides a Moorean response to these puzzles. Employing Nozick’s sensitivity requirement for knowledge, Black argues in “A Moorean Response to Brain-in-a-Vat Scepticism” that the only worlds that are relevant to whether or not S knows that p are those in which S’s belief is produced by the method that actually produces it. This means that BIV worlds—possible worlds in which S is a BIV—are not relevant to whether S knows that she’s not a BIV. For BIV worlds are worlds in which her belief is produced by a method other than the one that actually produces it. Thus, since BIV worlds are not relevant to whether S know things about the external world, S can know both that she has hands and that she’s not a BIV. This, too, suggests a Moorean response to our skeptical puzzles.

9. Conclusion

We have now characterized epistemological contextualism in a way that allows several different theories to count as versions of that position. We have seen in particular that epistemological contextualists maintain that certain features of conversational contexts shape the standards that one must meet in order for one’s beliefs to count as knowledge. Understood in this way, a fairly wide range of views will count as versions of epistemological contextualism. Different versions will disagree over which features of conversational contexts can shape the epistemic standards, and over how the relevant contextual features help to shape those standards. Yet in spite of the differences between versions of epistemological contextualism, each seeks to achieve the valuable ends of explaining our epistemic judgments and solving the puzzles that are generated by skeptical arguments.

10. References and Further Reading

Annis, David. (1978) “A Contextual Theory of Epistemic Justification.” American Philosophical Quarterly 15: 213-219.
Austin, J. L. (1979) “Other Minds.” In Philosophical Papers, 3rd ed. New York: Oxford University Press.
Black, Tim. (2002a) “A Moorean Response to Brain-in-a-Vat Scepticism.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 80: 148-163.
Black, Tim. (2002b) “Relevant Alternatives and the Shifting Standards for Knowledge.” Southwest Philosophy Review 18: 23-32.
Brueckner, Anthony. (1994) “The Shifting Content of Knowledge Attributions.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 54: 123-126.
Cohen, Stewart. (1986) “Knowledge and Context.” Journal of Philosophy 83: 574-583.
Cohen, Stewart. (1987) “Knowledge, Context, and Social Standards.” Synthese 73: 3-26.
Cohen, Stewart. (1988) “How to be a Fallibilist.” Philosophical Perspectives 2, Epistemology: 91-123.
Cohen, Stewart. (1998a) “Contextualist Solutions to Epistemological Problems: Scepticism, Gettier, and the Lottery.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 76: 289-306.
Cohen, Stewart. (1998b) “Two Kinds of Skeptical Argument.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 58: 143-159.
Cohen, Stewart. (1999) “Contextualism, Skepticism, and the Structure of Reasons.” Philosophical Perspectives 13, Epistemology: 57-89.
Cohen, Stewart. (2000a) “Contextualism and Skepticism.” Philosophical Issues 10, Skepticism: 94-107.
Cohen, Stewart. (2000b) “Replies [to Klein, Hawthorne, and Prades].” Philosophical Issues 10, Skepticism: 132-139.
Cohen, Stewart. (2001) “Contextualism Defended: Comments on Richard Feldman’s ‘Skeptical Problems, Contextualist Solutions’.” Philosophical Studies 103: 87-98.
DeRose, Keith. (1992) “Contextualism and Knowledge Attributions.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 52: 913-929.
DeRose, Keith. (1996a) “Knowledge, Assertion and Lotteries.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 74: 568-580.
DeRose, Keith. (1996b) “Relevant Alternatives and the Content of Knowledge Attributions.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 56: 193-197.
DeRose, Keith. (1999a) “Solving the Skeptical Problem.” Reprinted in Keith DeRose and Ted A. Warfield, eds., Skepticism: A Contemporary Reader. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
DeRose, Keith. (1999b) “Contextualism: An Explanation and Defense.” In John Greco and Ernest Sosa, eds., The Blackwell Guide to Epistemology. Oxford: Blackwell.
DeRose, Keith. (1999c) “Introduction: Responding to Skepticism.” In Keith DeRose and Ted A. Warfield, eds., Skepticism: A Contemporary Reader. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
DeRose, Keith. (2000a) “How Can We Know that We’re Not Brains In Vats?” Southern Journal of Philosophy 38 (Spindel Conference Supplement): 121-148.
DeRose, Keith. (2000b) “Now You Know It, Now You Don’t.” Proceedings of the Twentieth World Congress of Philosophy: Volume V, Epistemology: 91-106.
DeRose, Keith. (2002) “Assertion, Knowledge, and Context.” Philosophical Review 111 (2): 167-203.
DeRose, Keith. (2004)a “Single Scoreboard Semantics.” Philosophical Studies 119 (1-2): 1-21.
DeRose, Keith. (2004b) “Sosa, Safety, Sensitivity, and Skeptical Hypotheses.” In John Greco, ed., Sosa and His Critics. Oxford: Blackwell.
Dretske, Fred I. (1981) Knowledge and the Flow of Information. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Dretske, Fred I. (2000a) “Epistemic Operators.” In Perception, Knowledge and Belief: Selected Essays. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Dretske, Fred I. (2000b) “The Pragmatic Dimension of Knowledge.” In Perception, Knowledge and Belief: Selected Essays. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Feldman, Richard. (1999) “Contextualism and Skepticism.” Philosophical Perspectives 13, Epistemology: 91-114.
Feldman, Richard. (2001) “Skeptical Problems, Contextualist Solutions.” Philosophical Studies 103: 61-85.
Fogelin, Robert J. (1999) “The Sceptic’s Burden.” International Journal of Philosophical Studies 7: 159-172.
Garfinkel, Alan. (1981) Forms of Explanation. New Haven: Yale University Press.
Goldman, Alvin I. (1976) “Discrimination and Perceptual Knowledge.” Journal of Philosophy 73: 771-791.
Hambourger, Robert. (1987) “Justified Assertion and the Relativity of Knowledge.” Philosophical Studies 51: 241-269.
Hawthorne, John. (2002) “Lewis, the Lottery and the Preface.” Analysis 62: 242-251.
Heller, Mark. (1989) “Relevant Alternatives.” Philosophical Studies 55: 23-40.
Heller, Mark. (1999a) “The Proper Role for Contextualism in an Anti-Luck Epistemology.” Philosophical Perspectives 13, Epistemology: 115-129.
Heller, Mark. (1999b) “Relevant Alternatives and Closure.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 77: 196-208.
Hofweber, Thomas. (1999) “Contextualism and the Meaning-Intention Problem.” In Kepa Korta, Ernest Sosa, Xabier Arrazola, eds., Cognition, Agency and Rationality. Dordrecht: Kluwer.
Jacobson, Stephen. (2001) “Contextualism and Global Doubts about the World.” Synthese 129: 381-404.
Johnsen, Bredo C. (2001) “Contextualist Swords, Skeptical Plowshares.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 62: 385-406.
Klein, Peter. (2000) “Contextualism and the Real Nature of Academic Skepticism.” Philosophical Issues 10, Skepticism: 108-116.
Kornblith, Hilary. (2000) “The Contextualist Evasion of Epistemology.” Philosophical Issues 10, Skepticism: 24-32.
Lewis, David. (1979) “Scorekeeping in a Language Game.” Journal of Philosophical Logic 8: 339-359.
Lewis, David. (1986) “Causal Explanation.” In Philosophical Papers, Volume II. New York: Oxford University Press.
Lewis, David. (1996) “Elusive Knowledge.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 74: 549-567.
Lipton, Peter. (1990) “Contrastive Explanation.” In Dudley Knowles, ed., Explanation and its Limits. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Lipton, Peter. (1991) Inference to the Best Explanation. London: Routledge.
Neta, Ram. (2002) “S knows that p.” Noûs 36: 663-681.
Neta, Ram. (2003) “Contextualism and the Problem of the External World.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 66: 1-31.
Neta, Ram. (2003) “Skepticism, Contextualism, and Semantic Self-Knowledge.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 67 (2): 396–411.
Nozick, Robert. (1981) Philosophical Explanations. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
Oakley, I.T. (2001) “A Skeptic’s Reply to Lewisian Contextualism.” Canadian Journal of Philosophy 31: 309-332.
Pritchard, Duncan. (2000) “Closure and Context.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 78: 275-280.
Pritchard, Duncan. (2001) “Contextualism, Scepticism, and the Problem of Epistemic Descent.” Dialectica 55: 327-349.
Pritchard, Duncan. (2002) “Recent Work on Radical Skepticism.” American Philosophical Quarterly 39: 215-257.
Rieber, Steven. (1998) “Skepticism and Contrastive Explanation.” Noûs 32: 189-204.
Rysiew, Patrick. (2001) “The Context-Sensitivity of Knowledge Attributions.” Noûs 35: 477-514.
Schaffer, Jonathan. (2001) “Knowledge, Relevant Alternatives and Missed Clues.” Analysis 61: 202-208.
Schaffer, Jonathan. (2004a) “From Contextualism to Contrastivism.” Philosophical Studies, 119 (1-2): 73-104.
Schaffer, Jonathan. (2004b) “Skepticism, Contextualism, and Discrimination.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 69 (1): 138–155.
Schiffer, Stephen. (1996) “Contextualist Solutions to Scepticism.” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society 96: 317-333.
Shatz, David. (1981) “Reliability and Relevant Alternatives.” Philosophical Studies 39: 393-408.
Shuger, Scott. (1983) “Knowledge and its Consequences.” American Philosophical Quarterly 20: 217-225.
Sosa, Ernest. (1999) “How to Defeat Opposition to Moore.” Philosophical Perspectives 13, Epistemology: 141-153.
Sosa, Ernest. (2000a) “Skepticism and Contextualism.” Philosophical Issues 10, Skepticism: 1-18.
Sosa, Ernest. (2000b) “Replies [to Tomberlin, Kornblith, and Lehrer].” Philosophical Issues 10, Skepticism: 38-41.
Sosa, Ernest. (2004) “Relevant Alternatives, Contextualism Included.” Philosophical Studies, 119 (1-2): 35-65.
Stanley, Jason. (2000) “Context and Logical Form.” Linguistics and Philosophy 23: 391-434.
Stanley, Jason. (2004) “On the Linguistic Basis for Contextualism.” Philosophical Studies, 119 (1-2): 119-146.
Stine, Gail. (1976) “Skepticism, Relevant Alternatives, and Deductive Closure.” Philosophical Studies 29: 249-261.
Stone, Jim. (2000) “Skepticism as a Theory of Knowledge.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 60: 527-545.
Stroud, Barry. (1984) The Significance of Philosophical Scepticism. New York: Oxford University Press.
Unger, Peter. (1975) Ignorance: A Case for Scepticism. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Unger, Peter. (1984) Philosophical Relativity. Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press.
Unger, Peter. (1986) “The Cone Model of Knowledge.” Philosophical Topics 14: 125-178.
Vogel, Jonathan. (1987) “Tracking, Closure, and Inductive Knowledge.” In Steven Luper-Foy, ed., The Possibility of Knowledge: Nozick and His Critics. Totowa, NJ: Rowman and Littlefield.
Vogel, Jonathan. (1990) “Are There Counterexamples to the Closure Principle?” In Glenn Ross and Michael D. Roth, eds., Doubting: Contemporary Perspectives on Skepticism. Dordrecht: Reidel Publishing Company.
Vogel, Jonathan. (1997) “Skepticism and Foundationalism: A Reply to Michael Williams.” Journal of Philosophical Research 22: 11-28.
Vogel, Jonathan. (1999) “The New Relevant Alternatives Theory.” Philosophical Perspectives 13, Epistemology: 155-180.
Williams, Michael. (1988) “Epistemological Realism and the Basis of Scepticism.” Mind 97: 415-439.
Williams, Michael. (1996a) Unnatural Doubts: Epistemological Realism and the Basis of Scepticism. Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
Williams, Michael. (1996b) “Understanding Human Knowledge Philosophically.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 56: 359-378.
Williams, Michael. (1997) “Still Unnatural: A Reply to Vogel and Rorty.” Journal of Philosophical Research 22: 29-39.
Williams, Michael. (1999a) Groundless Belief: An Essay on the Possibility of Epistemology, 2nd ed. Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
Williams, Michael. (1999b) “Fogelin’s Neo-Pyrrhonism.” International Journal of Philosophical Studies 7: 141-158.
Williams, Michael. (2001) “Contextualism, Externalism and Epistemic Standards.” Philosophical Studies 103: 1-23.
Williamson, Timothy. (2001). “Comments on Michael Williams’ ‘Contextualism, Externalism and Epistemic Standards’.” Philosophical Studies 103: 25-33.
Yourgrau, Palle. (1983) “Knowledge and Relevant Alternatives.” Synthese 55: 175-190.

Author Information

Tim Black
Email: tim.black@csun.edu
California State University, Northridge
U. S. A.

Edward Caird (1835—1908)

caird A Scottish philosopher of the latter half of the nineteenth century, Edward Caird was one of the key figures of the idealist movement that dominated British philosophy from 1870 until the mid 1920s. Best known for his studies of Kant and Hegel, he argued that “Kantian philosophy is only a first stage, though of course a necessary stage, in the transition of philosophy to higher forms of Idealism.” Caird exercised a strong influence on the second generation of idealists, such as John Watson and Bernard Bosanquet. During his long and productive life, Caird was active in university and local politics and in educational and social reform. In his two series of Gifford lectures, he developed an important evolutionary account of religious conceptions ( the idea of the good, the soul, God, and the relation of God to humanity).

Biography
Critique of Kant and Hegel
Philosophical Style
Evolution and Religion
Reference and Further Reading

1. Biography

Edward Caird was born in Greenock, Scotland, on March 23, 1835. A younger brother of the theologian John Caird (1820-1898), Edward began his studies at the University of Glasgow (which he briefly abandoned due to ill health), later moving to Balliol College, Oxford, from which he graduated in 1863. Following his graduation, he became Tutor at Merton College, Oxford (1864-1866), but soon left for the Professorship of Moral Philosophy at Glasgow (1866-1893). There, in addition to carrying out his academic duties, Caird was active in university and local politics, and was responsible for establishing the study of political sciences at the University. Following the death of Benjamin Jowett (1817-1893), Caird returned to Oxford, where he served as Master of Balliol College until 1907. He was a founding fellow of the British Academy (1902), a corresponding member of the French Academy, and held honorary doctorates from the Universities of St Andrews (1883), Oxford (1891), Cambridge (1898) and Wales (1902).

Like many of the British idealists, Caird had a strong interest in classical literature. In his two volumes of Essays on Literature and Philosophy (1892), he brought together critical essays on Goethe, Rousseau, Carlyle, Dante and Wordsworth, with a discussion (in Volume II) of Cartesianism (Descartes, Malbranche and Spinoza) and metaphysics.

Caird’s politics were generally liberal and progressive. He supported the education of women, opposed the Anglo-Boer War (1899-1902) and, like Green, was involved in the ‘university settlement’ programs–particularly in Glasgow and in London–where recent university graduates and professionals attempted to narrow the gap between social classes by living and working among and with the poor.

In 1907, Caird resigned his position as Master of Balliol, and died the following year on November 1. He is buried in St Sepulchre’s Cemetery, Oxford, alongside Jowett and Green.

2. Critique of Kant and Hegel

Along with T.H. Green (1836-1882), Caird was one of the first generation of British idealists, whose philosophical work was largely in reaction to the then-dominant empiricist and associationist views of Alexander Bain (1818-1903) and J.S. Mill. He had, however, an ability of literary expression which Green did not possess; he was also more inclined to discuss questions by the method of tracing the historical development of the ideas involved. But while Green died at the early age of 47, Caird enjoyed a relatively long and productive life. It is, in part, for this reason that he exercised such a strong influence—particularly on the relation of philosophy and religion—on later idealists such as John Watson (1847-1939) and Bernard Bosanquet (1848-1923). Though often considered to be Hegelian, Caird was arguably more profoundly influenced by Kant, although he was far from an uncritical reader.

Caird’s first major work was A Critical Account of the Philosophy of Kant (1877), focusing on the Critique of Pure Reason and the Prolegomena to any Future Metaphysics. It was superseded in 1889 by The Critical Philosophy of Immanuel Kant (two volumes) in which Caird wished to show the relation of the three Critiques and the continuity in the movement of Kant’s thought. In general, Caird was convinced that, though Kant had inaugurated a new era in philosophy with his attempt to integrate the a priori and the a posteriori, he failed to carry out this task fully. It was here that Caird’s idealism took over. In these volumes on Kant, Caird sought “to display in the very argument of the great metaphysician, who was supposed to have cut the world in two with a hatchet, an almost involuntary but continuous and inevitable regression towards objective organic unity.” Thus, he argued that “Kantian philosophy is only a first stage, though of course a necessary stage, in the transition of philosophy to higher forms of Idealism.” (1877, p. 667)

A sympathetic exposition of Hegel’s philosophy is contained in his monograph on Hegel (1883) and, in 1885, his Social Philosophy and Religion of Comte (based on a collection of articles that had been previously published in the magazine, Contemporary Review) appeared. In these two works, Caird critically interprets these authors on lines of his own. Concerning Comte, for example, Caird writes that there cannot be a ‘religion of Humanity’ that is not, at the same time, a religion of God. In his treatment of Hegel, as of Kant, Caird’s purpose was to show that there is a center of unity to which the mind must come back out of all differences, however varied and alien in appearance. The analysis was preliminary to reconstruction.

3. Philosophical Style

Caird’s way of philosophizing differed from that of many of his contemporaries. It was consistently and even obtrusively constructive. According to Caird, “the true manner of honoring a thinker is to force oneself to understand him from his own point of view,” and only then “to submit his ideas to as objective an examination as possible.” Thus, he seized on the truths contained in the authors with whom he dealt, and was only incidentally concerned with their errors. One of the results of this, however, was that Caird’s own views are often to be found only indirectly–that is, in his exposition and commentary of the views of others.

4. Evolution and Religion

Like many other idealists, such as D.G. Ritchie (1853-1903), Caird was concerned to show the relation of evolutionary theory to the development of thought and culture. His first set of Gifford lectures, The Evolution of Religion (2 volumes, 1893), deals less than his other works with an exposition of the views of other philosophers. These lectures focussed on the possibility of a science of religion and the nature of religion from Greek times, but were especially centered on the development of the Christian faith through to the Reformation. Caird shows the spiritual sense of humanity as at first dominated by the object, but constrained by its own abstractions to swing around so as to fall under the sway of the subject.

In 1904 Caird’s second set of Gifford lectures, The Evolution of Theology in the Greek Philosophers,appeared. Here, he provides again an evolutionary account of religious conceptions (e.g., the idea of the good, the soul, God, and the relation of God to humanity) toward a ‘reflective religion’ or theology. The story of Greek philosophy, which Caird considered mainly (but not exclusively) in its relation to theology, was carried from Plato through Aristotle, the Stoics, and Philo, to Plotinus and–in the final lecture–to Christian theology and St. Augustine.

In general, Caird’s views on religion were importantly related to his understanding of ethics, and Caird borrows from Hegel (and Goethe) the ethical idea of self sacrifice, or “dying to live,” which was to have an important role in the work of Bosanquet. Caird consistently emphasized the importance of religion, and that a genuine metaphysics must be able to provide an account of it.

5. References and Further Reading

The Collected Works of Edward Caird, 12 Volumes, Ed. and Introd. Colin Tyler, Bristol, UK: Thoemmes Press, 1999.
A Critical Account of the Philosophy of Kant, with an Historical Introduction. Glasgow: J. Maclehose, 1877.
The Problem of Philosophy at the Present Time: an Introductory Address Delivered to the Philosophical Society of the University of Edinburgh. Glasgow, James Maclehose & sons, 1881. (43 p.)
Hegel, Philadelphia: J. B. Lippincott and co.; Edinburgh: W. Blackwood and sons, 1883.
The Social Philosophy and Religion of Comte. Glasgow: J. Maclehose and sons, 1885. New York, Macmillan, 1885.
The Moral Aspect of the Economical Problem; Presidential Address to the Ethical Society. London, Swan Sonnenschein, Lowrey & Co., 1888. (18 p.)
The Critical Philosophy of Immanuel Kant, Glasgow: J. Maclehose & sons, 1889; New York: Macmillan, 1889. 2 v.
Essays on Literature and Philosophy, Glasgow, J. Maclehose and sons, 1892. 2 v. [v. 1. Dante in his relation to the theology and ethics of the Middle Ages. Goethe and philosophy. Rousseau. Wordsworth. The problem of philosophy at the present time. The genius of Carlyle; v. 2. Cartesianism. Metaphysic.]
The Evolution of Religion. 2 v., Glasgow: James Maclehose, 1893; New York: Macmillan, 1893. [Gifford lectures; 1890/1891-1891/1892]
Address on Plato’s Republic as the Earliest Educational Treatise, Delivered by Edward Caird at the Closing Ceremony of the Session 1893-94. Bangor: Jarvis & Foster, 1894 (22 p.)
The Evolution of Theology in the Greek Philosophers. 2 v., Glasgow: J. Maclehose and sons, 1904. [Gifford lectures, Glasgow; 1900/1901 and 1901-1902].
Idealism and the Theory of Knowledge. London: Henry Frowde, 1903 (14 p.)
Lay Sermons and Addresses : Delivered in the Hall of Balliol College, Oxford. Glasgow : J. Maclehose; New York: Macmillan, 1907.

The standard assessment of Caird’s work is:

The Life and Philosophy of Edward Caird by Sir Henry Jones and John Henry Muirhead. Glasgow: Maclehose, Jackson and co., 1921.

The IEP desires a newer and more detailed article on Caird.

Author Information

Revised by William Sweet
U. S. A.

Transcendental Arguments

Transcendental arguments are partly non-empirical, often anti-skeptical arguments focusing on necessary enabling conditions either of coherent experience or the possession or employment of some kind of knowledge or cognitive ability, where the opponent is not in a position to question the fact of this experience, knowledge, or cognitive ability, and where the revealed preconditions include what the opponent questions. Such arguments take as a premise some obvious fact about our mental life—such as some aspect of our knowledge, our experience, our beliefs, or our cognitive abilities—and add a claim that some other state of affairs is a necessary condition of the first one. Transcendental arguments most commonly have been deployed against a position denying the knowability of some extra-mental proposition, such as the existence of other minds or a material world. Thus these arguments characteristically center on a claim that, for some extra-mental proposition P, the indisputable truth of some general proposition Q about our mental life requires that P. Eighteenth Century Prussian philosopher Immanuel Kant is usually credited with introducing the systematic use of the transcendental argument. His use of it included arguments aimed at refuting epistemic skepticism, as well as arguments with the more fundamental purpose of showing the legitimacy of the application of certain concepts—in particular those of substance and cause—to experience. Later scholars have developed a variety of general objections to the transcendental argument strategy. In response, some recent and contemporary philosophers have offered updated strategies similar in form to transcendental arguments, but with less controversial premises and/or more modest goals.

Transcendental Reasoning and Skepticism
The Modal Objection
The Analytic/Criteriological Approach
The Verificationism/Idealism Objection
The Uniqueness-of-Conceptual-Framework Objection
Modest Transcendental Arguments
Objections to Modest Transcendental Arguments
A More Modest Project for Kant
Prospects for Strong Transcendental Arguments
References and Further Reading

1. Transcendental Reasoning and Skepticism

“Transcendental” reasoning, for Kant, is reasoning pertaining to the necessary conditions of experience. Though he did coin the term “transcendental argument” in a different context, Kant actually did not use it to refer to transcendental arguments as they are understood today. He did sometimes use the term “transcendental deduction” for a range of arguments concerning the necessary conditions of coherent experience. Early uses of the term “transcendental argument” for arguments of this type have been noted in Charles Peirce and J. L. Austin. Often, the purpose of a transcendental argument is to answer a variety of epistemic skepticism by showing that the skeptical position itself (or its expression) implies or presupposes the possibility of the very knowledge in question. In this way, as Kant puts it in his Critique of Pure Reason, “the game played by idealism [is] turned against itself.” The skeptic is shown to presuppose the very facts he or she calls into question. (Kant also had a more modest use for transcendental arguments pertaining merely to establishing the applicability of certain fundamental concepts; see Section 8, below.)

Kant’s anti-skeptical arguments were inspired by a number of figures, but his primary concern was with what he saw as the empiricist skepticism of David Hume. In his Treatise of Human Nature, Hume argues that all ideas are derived from simple sense-impressions, simple impressions of reflection, and reflection on the mind’s operations. He goes on to argue that complex ideas of material objects are not fully grounded in the data of the senses, but are based in part on psychological propensities to pass from one idea to another. Our senses do not present us with the characteristics of mind-independence and perdurance; rather, our experience consists in sequences of impressions, some of which exhibit a resembling constancy with each other over time. To this picture, Hume argues, we must add an imaginative propensity to identify, and thus attribute continued existence to, impressions exhibiting constancy and coherency. Since the distinctness of these impressions conflicts with our propensity to identify them, we posit enduring and independent items that are responsible for various subjective impressions. One natural conclusion from this line of reasoning is that, whatever compulsion we might feel to acknowledge external, material things, neither reason nor the senses can be said to yield knowledge of such items.

Kant addresses skepticism about the material world most directly with his “Refutation of Idealism” in the second edition Critique of Pure Reason. There he argues that the possibility of recognizing the time-order of one’s own perceptions depends on the application of the concept of alteration to one’s own mental states. And in order for us to possess and apply the concept of alteration, it must be exhibited in the sensory experience of objective alteration. This experience cannot be based on patterns or regularities in experience (including its constancy and coherence), since the recognition of any such pattern depends on the organization of one’s experiences in time. The possibility of the organization of one’s own experiences in time (and even recognizing that one’s own states have a determinate time-order at all) requires relating changes in those experiences to objective alterations. Since we do make judgments about the time-order of our own experiences, we must have experienced objective alteration.

Kant’s answer to the skeptic thus takes roughly the following form:

(1) I make judgments about the temporal order of my own mental states.
(2) I could not make judgments about the temporal order of my own mental states without having experienced enduring substances independent of me undergoing alteration.
(3) Hence independent, enduring substances exist.

He thus establishes a claim to knowledge of the existence of enduring, independent objects by showing that the skeptic is committed to something (in this case, consciousness of one’s own perceptions as ordered in time) that is impossible without the existence of such objects. The skeptic thus is either committed to the existence of such things by virtue of accepting the obvious fact that we are conscious of our own perceptions as ordered in time, or presumes the existence of such things in the very attempt to raise doubt about it. This result would license the conclusion that we have knowledge of material objects, or at least that skepticism about the very existence of such items is incoherent.

Kant’s refutation of skepticism matches the template for a common understanding of the classical form of a transcendental argument:

(1) Some proposition Q about our mental life, the truth of which is immediately apparent or presumed by the skeptic’s position.
(2) The truth of some extra-mental proposition P, our knowledge of which is questioned by the skeptic, is a necessary condition of Q.
(3) Therefore P.

Transcendental arguments are further distinguished by the fact that the necessity they draw on is, characteristically, neither empirical nor analytic necessity. Rather, claims like those found in the second premise imply some claim to synthetic a priori knowledge—knowledge of substantive facts about the world derived by a priori metaphysical reasoning. If such claims were based on empirical observation, they would beg the question against most relevant forms of skepticism; if these claims were merely analytic, then it is unlikely any substantive conclusion could be derived from them.

Transcendental arguments can be characterized as demonstrations that the skeptic’s articulation of her own position is self-defeating in some way. These arguments imply that the skeptic cannot even coherently articulate a given position. Epicurus is reported to have argued that, without free choice, one assents to propositions only because one is determined to do so. Without free choice, then, it would be impossible to rationally assent to any proposition—that is, to assent to it because one has good reasons to think it is true, rather than because one must. The proposition that one has no free choice is thus self-stultifying, in that, if true, it cannot be warranted. This reasoning implies the following argument:

(1) I am able to rationally assent to the proposition that there is no free choice.
(2) I could not rationally assent to any proposition if there were no free choice.
(3) Hence, there is free choice.

Hilary Putnam (1981), drawing on his concept of content-externalism, holds that we cannot refer to brains and vats if we are brains in vats who have never actually experienced such things. If we have never had contact with external objects, our language is “Vat-English,” rather than English. Since reference, in his view, is partly determined by its context and causal history, it would be impossible for a permanent brain-in-a-vat to raise doubts about whether she is a brain in a vat. Given this theory of reference, the proposition that all persons are and have always been brains in vats is self-defeating, in that it is either false or not affirmable by anyone. Insofar as the skeptic supposes that the issue is a legitimate one to raise, she presupposes that the relevant concern is moot:

(1) I am able to raise the question as to whether all persons have always been brains in vats.
(2) I could not refer to brains in vats unless some person (that is, myself) were acquainted with such things.
(3) Hence, it is not the case that all persons have always been brains in vats.

Finally, it is an implication of Kant’s reasoning in the Refutation of Idealism that the proposition that no one has had any contact with material objects would be literally unthinkable without contact with material objects to give one a sense of an objective system of temporal relations (in turn enabling inner time-determination). If Kant is right, then such a proposition is performatively self-falsifying in the strongest sense: the possibility of the skeptic articulating her own position would prove its falsity.

2. The Modal Objection

One general objection commonly raised against transcendental arguments concerns the very type of necessity transcendental arguments rely upon. Transcendental arguments characteristically center on a claim to synthetic a priori knowledge. Take, for example, Kant’s claim that the experience of enduring objects undergoing alteration is a precondition of subjective time-consciousness. This claim is neither grounded in experience nor follows from the meanings of the terms involved. He does provide some (often rather obscure) reasoning to support this claim, but that support, again, typically involves claims to synthetic a priori knowledge. Such claims have been portrayed as ultimately relying on a mysterious faculty of philosophical intuition, of insight into the natures of things not grounded in observation or experiment, the legitimacy of which is at least as doubtful as sensory perception or empirical inference.

3. The Analytic/Criteriological Approach

Partly in response to concerns about the modality of Kantian transcendental arguments, and in response to allied concerns about claims to synthetic a priori knowledge, Peter Strawson, Jonathan Bennett, and others have promoted a strategy structurally similar to Kant’s, but which is intended to avoid such problematic claims. Their strategy is analytic, in that it concerns relationships between beliefs or concepts and the conceptual frameworks needed to give those beliefs or concepts their content.

In Individuals, Strawson (1959) offers a transcendental argument purporting to demonstrate the existence of other minds. He argues that, to employ the concept of one’s own mind in the self-ascription of mental states, one must be able to distinguish between one’s own mental states and the mental states of others. This requires the ability to predicate mental states of both oneself and others. But, he continues, in order to employ (or understand) any general concept one needs criteria for its application. In order to ascribe mental states to oneself, then, one must be in possession of logically adequate criteria (that is to say, behavioral criteria) for ascribing mental states to others.

Strawson’s (1966) approach in The Bounds of Sense to reconstructing Kant’s Refutation of Idealism argument works similarly. His reconstruction states that, to give content to the idea of one’s being in some particular conscious state at some particular time, one needs “the idea of a system of temporal relations which comprehends more than those experiences themselves.” One’s experiences thus must be taken as experiences of things independent of oneself with their own temporal order. The idea of temporal order, he argues, cannot be gleaned from one’s own case alone; the application of the concept of temporal ordering depends on the possession and application of a concept of objectivity. But does the requirement that one have and apply the concept of an objective order guarantee that there really exists such an order? Is it not sufficient that we think there is one? Similarly, is it not sufficient for the self-ascription of mental states that we think there are other minds? Strawson’s reply rests on his “principle of significance,” which states that “there can be no legitimate, or even meaningful, employment of ideas or concepts which does not relate them to empirical or experiential conditions of their application.” One’s assessment of the analytic/criteriological approach depends on one’s assessment of this verificationism-inspired principle.

4. The Verificationism/Idealism Objection

In a much-cited essay, Barry Stroud (1968) argues that, to any claim that the truth of some proposition is a necessary condition of some fact about our mental life, the skeptic can always reply that it would be enough for it merely to appear to be true, or for us merely to believe that it is true. Transcendental arguments, he claims, at best demonstrate how things must appear, or what we must believe, rather than how things must be. Anti-skeptical transcendental arguments of familiar sorts are thus left with a gap to fill. Stroud’s contention—which is now widely accepted—is that such arguments, when aimed at refuting epistemic skepticism, can only close that gap by adverting either to a sort of verificationism or to idealism. In the case of Strawson’s arguments above, even supposing that we must be in possession of some criteria for applying concepts of other minds and/or an objective world, this fact only has anti-skeptical consequences if we also accept that there is no meaningful concept-application without experiential criteria sufficient for knowing whether the concept is instantiated. As Stroud points out, such a principle is implausible. Further, if we accepted such a principle, other aspects of transcendental arguments would be superfluous. All we would have to show is that we meaningfully employ external-world concepts; it would be impossible for any form of skepticism to be meaningful or intelligible.

As Stroud goes on to point out, another way of closing the gap between it being necessary that things appear a certain way and things being that way, would be to embrace an idealism that reduces how things are to how things appear, or must appear, to us. Kant did not rely on any verificationist principle in making the case against skepticism, but according to many scholars his “transcendental idealism” made possible the jump from how things must be experienced by us to how things must be by reducing objects of experience to mere mental representations. But such idealism is unacceptable to most: embracing idealism to answer the epistemic skeptic results in a Pyrrhic victory at best.

Despite Stroud’s blanket assertion, it should be noted that the verification/idealism objection only applies on a case-by-case basis. Some arguments that take the form of transcendental arguments may have other deficiencies, but do not rely on either verificationism or idealism. A few scholars have observed that Descartes’s “Cogito, ergo sum” argument can be re-conceived as a transcendental argument:

(1) I think.
(2) In order to think “I think,” it is necessary to exist.
(3) Hence, I exist.

This argument meets the criteria for a transcendental argument: it takes a fact about one’s mental life as a premise, adds that some extra-mental fact is a necessary condition of the truth of that premise, and concludes that the extra-mental fact holds. This argument would turn on the claim that the statement, “I do not exist” (or better, the proposition that no one exists) is performatively self-defeating in the sense that the fact of its performance counts as conclusive evidence against its truth. That is what connects the mental fact (I am thinking about whether I exist) to the relevant extra-mental fact (I exist). Regardless of how this argument might fail in some other respect, it presupposes neither verificationism nor idealism in closing the gap between the internal and the external.

5. The Uniqueness-of-Conceptual-Framework Objection

Another important general objection to transcendental arguments concerns the hidden assumption requiring the uniqueness of the conceptual scheme that is held to be a precondition of experience in any given transcendental argument. Kant, for example, argues that experience is only possible if certain concepts are applied a priori in its organization, such as the concepts of substance and cause. Strawson similarly argues that experience is only possible via the application of the concept of an objective system of temporal relations. Stephan Körner (1974), however, famously characterized arguments resting on such claims as hopeless, because there is no way to establish the uniqueness of the relevant conceptual precondition. His concern is that other conceptual schemes and principles—perhaps unimaginable to us—might suffice as well. But if such schemes cannot be ruled out, then the validity of any such argument cannot be decisively established. All transcendental arguments make some claim about necessary enabling conditions. Given that the sense of necessity in question is not logical, how can the uniqueness of the enabling conditions ever be shown?

6. Modest Transcendental Arguments

In response to some of these concerns Stroud has proposed that we keep transcendental arguments, but moderate the goal we hope to achieve with them (Stroud 1994 and 1999). The goal of a “modest” transcendental argument is just to show the indispensability of some belief, concept, or conceptual framework. The conclusion such arguments hope to draw is not a refutation of some variety of epistemic skepticism via a demonstration of the alternative, but rather a demonstration of the unintelligibility of the skeptical position. The idea is that, by showing that it is impossible consistently to maintain a given position, one also shows that it is legitimate to ignore it. Arguments of this sort seek to show that beliefs about, say, an external world or other minds are indispensable to coherent experience or the use of language.

The modest strategy in replying to external-world skepticism would be to concede that one cannot prove transcendentally that there is an external world, but to show that one must believe in such a world, or presuppose such a world as part of one’s interpretive framework, as a precondition of coherent experience. This, Stroud argues, would be sufficient to entitle one to ignore external-world skepticism. We are entitled to hold a belief, according to this line of thought, if that belief can be shown to be incorrigible or invulnerable to correction.

One major advantage to modest transcendental arguments is that they are not subject to the verificationism/idealism objection. All that such arguments seek to show is that we must believe a certain way, not that the world must be a certain way. Thus there is no gap to be closed between showing that the world must appear a certain way and eliminating the possibility that the world really is not that way.

7. Objections to Modest Transcendental Arguments

Arguments relying on the relative necessity of some conceptual framework or set of beliefs, however, are subject to certain general objections. A version of Körner’s uniqueness objection still seems applicable. To provide some response to the epistemic skeptic, an indispensability argument would have to show that a given belief is indispensable as such, rather than just indispensable for us. And to do that is impossible; we can only argue for the uniqueness of a conceptual or doxastic framework on the basis of our own concepts and beliefs. As Stern (2000) puts it, if indispensability “is weaker than infallibility in so far as it leaves open the possibility that our belief that p is false, how can p be immune from doubt?; and if it is immune from doubt though possibly false, isn’t this a vice rather than a virtue?” If the “necessity” of some set of beliefs or conceptual framework just follows from our own inability to think outside that framework, then the discovery of this necessity is just a discovery about our own limitations, rather than a discovery about the world around us. Indispensability may indeed be all a modest transcendental argument needs to show that skepticism is inert (for us), but is this an interesting result if it stems just from our own incapacities?

This kind of concern is reflected in a challenge to the classical claim that radical skepticism about reason is self-defeating. How can we know that logical inference really is truth-preserving? How can we know that the principle of non-contradiction is true? It would seem that such a skeptical position is unanswerable, because any answer involves argument, which presupposes the validity of deductive inference. But, as Aristotle first suggested in his Metaphysics, when one makes a statement asserting the impossibility of rationally supporting any claim one makes, one presupposes the theoretical possibility of claims being rationally supported (c.f. Meynell 1984). The framework under which we suppose that it is possible to rationally support claims is, in other words, indispensable, and the belief that it is possible to do so is invulnerable. This argument is, effectively, a modest transcendental argument.

But why can’t the skeptic make the same point while limiting herself to asking for proof of the universal and necessary validity of deductive inference? The skeptic need not on this approach make some claim to the effect that statements may not be rationally supportable (a claim, in other words, that itself calls for support). An inherent inconsistency in the affirmation of some such claim need not, then, be a concern (see Fowler 1987). In asking for proof, of course, the skeptic in some way implies that there is at least some prima facie doubt with regard to the operation of reason in finding truth. So in that way the skeptic must be implying at least a prima facie possibility that reason is inadequate to that task.

A modest transcendental argument establishing the indispensability of a conceptual framework has the effect of reducing the skeptic either to inconsistency or to raising doubts in the abstract. Since the alternative is inconceivable, the skeptic cannot consistently commit to the possibility of the alternative. Yet it seems too quick to go directly from showing that some conceptual framework is necessary for us to deny any relevance to questions about the truth of the framework. It is not clear, then, that any modest transcendental argument really renders its target skepticism inert. Even if the skeptic is shown to be unable consistently to raise a certain possibility, that possibility is not thereby taken out of contention. However abstract (or even inexpressible) the doubt may be that remains, the modest transcendental argument falls short of establishing epistemic entitlement.

8. A More Modest Project for Kant

There is another kind of modest application of transcendental arguments that is not subject to the above concerns, owing to its pursuit of a different kind of result. Part of Kant’s project is not so much concerned with responding to the epistemic skeptic as with responding to an opponent who questions the very conceptual legitimacy of external-world concepts like substance and cause. Despite an emphasis in contemporary philosophy on epistemic skepticism, for Kant conceptual legitimacy appears to be the primary or fundamental application of transcendental reasoning. This project is the major concern of his “Transcendental Deduction of the Categories” in the Critique of Pure Reason. He employs a legal metaphor at the beginning of his defense of our use of such conceptsto distinguish between “what is lawful (quid juris) and that which concerns the fact (quid facti).” His avowed focus, then, is on the “lawfulness” of our application of external-world concepts. He is concerned, as a first goal at least, with the applicability (or “objective validity”) of these concepts quite independently of their instantiation. That this should be a primary goal for Kant makes a lot of sense in light of some of his major precursors. Though in other respects having very different views, Leibniz, Berkeley, and Hume each questioned the legitimacy of the application of concepts like substance and cause to experience. Leibniz denied not only the existence of material substance but its metaphysical possibility. Because matter is infinitely divisible, he argued, it cannot be a basic constituent of the universe. Only minds can be substances, so the concept of substance is not even appropriately applied to matter. Berkeley argued that all we can describe are our ideas, and there is no sense in saying that ideas resemble material objects or their qualities. Talk of material objects independent of the mind is incoherent. Finally, Hume argued that it is impossible to find a source for the concepts of substance and cause in perception sufficient to explain either the occurrence or even the content of such ideas.

Leibniz, Berkeley, and Hume all have in common, then, the position that external-world concepts like substance and cause are either incoherent or inapplicable to perceptual experience. In modern terms, they held that such application, if possible at all, is a category mistake. It is not difficult to see how at least part of Kant’s project in his transcendental deduction of these concepts is to refute this view, as distinguished from the project of proving that we veridically experience a world of causally-related substances. His strategy in doing so is notoriously hard to pin down, but the gist of it is that he claims that the concept of an objective world (which would include the concepts of substance and cause) is needed as an organizing principle—a rule or set of rules—for reproducing and synthesizing in judgment one’s various and otherwise inherently unconnected representations. For example, because all experience qua one’s subjective flow of perceptions is successive, the concept of cause is needed to distinguish between a succession of experiences representing the experience of an object (which could be experienced differently and yet be thought of as the same object) and a succession of experiences representing the experience of an event (the order of the stages of which determines the way it can be experienced). Because the thought of a causal relationship between event-stages is constitutive of the thought of an event, and because distinguishing between an accidental and externally-determined sequence of experiences is necessary to time-determination, the a priori possession of the concept of cause is a necessary condition of coherent experience.

The legitimacy of the concepts of substance and cause would also be a consequence of some of Kant’s more explicitly anti-skeptical arguments. A consequence of his reasoning in the “Refutation of Idealism,” for example, is that objective time-determination is implicated in subjective time-determination. The application of concepts relevant to determining an objective time-order (as the concepts of substance and cause are, he had explained earlier) is inseparable from subjective self-awareness. Since each of Kant’s precursors allow for an inner mental life, they cannot consistently deny the legitimacy of applying concepts like substance and cause to perceptual experience. This would not prove the existence of causally-related material substances, but it would accomplish quite a lot: it would demonstrate the inadequacy, in a certain respect, of Leibnizian metaphysics, Berkeleyan phenomenalism, and Humean empiricism.

9. Prospects for Strong Transcendental Arguments

Defenders of strong anti-skeptical transcendental arguments still exist. Kenneth Westphal (2003), for example, is more confident than most that some of Kant’s core transcendental arguments can be successful. He believes that the process by which Kant identifies our basic cognitive capacities and their enabling conditions (Westphal calls this “epistemic reflection”) has been confused with simple introspection, which is an empirical enterprise concerned with the contents of one’s consciousness. He argues that Kant does convincingly show that we legitimately apply certain concepts a priori as a necessary condition of coherent consciousness, and that there are, in fact, “perduring, perceptible, causally interacting physical objects.”

Despite Kant’s remaining defenders, however, few now believe that transcendental arguments can yield a direct refutation of epistemic skepticism. Most now agree that more modest goals are in order if such arguments are to remain relevant. Such modest variations on the transcendental argument form continue to appear in a variety of contexts.

10. References and Further Reading

Aristotle, Metaphysics, Book Γ.
Austin, J.L. (1939). “Are There A Priori Concepts?”, Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society 18.
Bardon, Adrian (forthcoming). “The Aristotelian Prescription: Skepticism, Retortion, and Transcendental Arguments,” International Philosophical Quarterly.
Bardon, Adrian (2004). “Kant’s Empiricism in His Refutation of Idealism,” Kantian Review 8.
Bardon, Adrian (2005). “Performative Transcendental Arguments,” Philosophia 33.
Bennett, Jonathan (1966). Kant’s Analytic (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press).
Berkeley, George (1979). Three Dialogues between Hylas and Philonous, ed. by Robert Adams (Indianapolis: Hackett).
Brueckner, Anthony (1983). “Transcendental Arguments I.” Noûs 17, pp. 551-76.
Brueckner, Anthony (1984). “Transcendental Arguments II.” Noûs 18, pp. 197-225.
Cassam, Quassim (1999). Self and World (Oxford: Oxford University Press).
Cassam, Quassim (1987). “Transcendental Arguments, Transcendental Synthesis, and Transcendental Idealism,” Philosophical Quarterly 37.
Davidson, Donald (1984). Inquiries into Truth and Interpretation (Oxford: Oxford University Press).
Fowler, Corbin (1987). “Scepticism Revisited,” Philosophy 62, pp. 385-88.
Genova, A.C. (1984). “Good Transcendental Arguments.” Kant-Studien 75, pp. 469-95.
Gram, Moltke (1975). “Why Must We Revisit Transcendental Arguments?” The Journal of Philosophy 72, pp. 624-6.
Guyer, Paul (1987). Kant and the Claims of Knowledge. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press).
Hintikka, Jaakko (1962). “Cogito, Ergo Sum: Inference or Performance?”, The Philosophical Review 71.
Hume, David (1978). A Treatise of Human Nature, 2nd ed. (Oxford: The Clarendon Press).
Kant, Immanuel (1998). Critique of Pure Reason, ed. and trans. by Paul Guyer and Allen Wood (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press).
Körner, Stephan (1974). Categorial Frameworks (Oxford: Basil Blackwell).
Leibniz, G.W. (1998). Monadology, in G.W. Leibniz: Philosophical Texts, trans. by Richard Franks and R.S. Woolhouse (Oxford: Oxford University Press).
Lewis, C.I. (1946). An Analysis of Knowledge and Valuation. (La Salle: Open Court).
Lewis, C.I. (1969) Values and Imperatives, ed. by J. Lange (Stanford: Stanford University Press).
Lipson, Morris (1987). “Objective Experience.” Noûs 21, pp. 319-43.
Lonergan, Bernard (1970). Insight (New York: Philosophical Library).
Meynell, Hugo (1984). “Scepticism Reconsidered,” Philosophy 59, pp. 431-42 .
Peirce, C.S. (1931 & 1958). Collected Papers of Charles Sanders Peirce, 8 vols., vols. i-iv ed. C. Hartshorne and P. Weiss (Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1931-5), vols. vii-viii ed. A. Burks Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1958).
Putnam, Hilary (1981). Reason, Truth, and History (New York: Cambridge University Press).
Rosenberg, Jay F. (1975). “Transcendental Arguments Revisited.” The Journal of Philosophy 72, pp. 611-24.
Schaper, Eva (1972). “Arguing Transcendentally,” Kant-Studien 63, pp. 101-16.
Stern, Robert (2000). Transcendental Arguments and Skepticism (Oxford: Oxford University Press).
Strawson, P.F. (1966). The Bounds of Sense (London: Methuen & Co.).
Strawson, P.F. (1959). Individuals (New York: Methuen & Co.).
Strawson, P.F. (1985). Skepticism and Naturalism: Some Varieties (New York: Columbia University Press).
Stroud, Barry (1999). “The Goal of Transcendental Arguments,” in Robert Stern (ed.), Transcendental Arguments: Problems and Prospects (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1999).
Stroud, Barry (1994). “Kantian Argument, Conceptual Capacities, and Invulnerability,” in Paolo Parrini (ed.), Kant and Contemporary Epistemology ( Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers).
Stroud, Barry (1968). “Transcendental Arguments,” Journal of Philosophy 65 (1968).
Westphal, Kenneth (2003). “Epistemic Reflection and Transcendental Proof,” in Strawson and Kant, ed. by Hans-Johann Glock (Oxford: Oxford University Press).

Author Information

Adrian Bardon
Email: bardona@wfu.edu
Wake Forest University
U. S. A.

George Santayana (1863—1952)

George Santayana was an influential 20th century American thinker whose philosophy connected a rich diversity of historical perspectives, culminating in a unique and unrivaled form of materialism, one recommending a bold reconciliation of spirit and nature. Santayana was also a poet, and he wrote a work of fiction, The Last Puritan, that was a Book of the Month Club selection in 1936, the same year he adorned the cover of Time magazine. Though he spent his formative intellectual life in America and ultimately is best categorized philosophically in that tradition, Santayana spent the better part of his life and publishing career in Europe. He spent his early childhood in his birth-country of Spain and throughout his expansive travels and residencies never relinquished his native citizenship. Displaying in both composition and criticism a prodigious literary imagination, Santayana’s writings appealed to a wide audience, and he remains to this day one of the most quoted of twentieth century thinkers. Probably the most well-known sentence of Santayana’s is also one of the least accurately quoted: “Those who cannot remember the past are condemned to repeat it” (The Life of Reason: Reason in Common Sense. Scribner’s, 1905: 284). Scholarly interest in Santayana today remains modest but diverse. Santayana was a thinker of rare stature whose work deserves the highest compliment of all: it can and may well still be read millennia from now.

Life
Writings
Philosophy
Naturalism in World Perspective
Legacy
References and Further Reading

1. Life

George Santayana was born on December 16, 1863 in Madrid, Spain. He lived his first eight years in Spain, his next forty years in Boston, and his last forty years in Europe. Accordingly, Santayana arranged his life in his autobiography, Persons and Places, in three parts: (1) “Background,” (2) “On Both Sides of the Atlantic,” and (3) “All on One Side.” The Background (1863-1886) encompassed his childhood in Ávila, Spain, through his undergraduate years at Harvard. The second period, during which Santayana traveled between the U.S. and Europe, covered his Harvard years (1886-1912), both as graduate student (Ph.D. 1889) and professor. The third period (1912-1952) was that of the retired professor writing and traveling in Europe, and eventually adopting Rome as his center of activity.

Santayana’s birth name was Jorge Agustín Nicolás Ruiz de Santayana. At the time of his birth Santayana’s father, Agustín Ruiz de Santayana, had only in the last few years met and married Josefina Borrás Sturgis, the recent widow of a Boston merchant named George Sturgis. While Agustín and Josefina united long enough to marry and produce young Jorge (the only child of their union), the two would ultimately part ways. Receiving financial support from her brother-in-law Robert (George Sturgis died leaving her little), Josefina decided to move herself and her surviving Sturgis children to Boston while for eight years young George and his father remained in Ávila. In 1872, father and son made the twelve-day sea voyage to Boston where Agustín briefly attempted to settle in with his wife and her Sturgis children, and, failing to do so, left young George with them to return to Spain in the spring of 1873. This early uprooting and estrangement from his father surely had a deep emotional impact on Santayana, and indeed in his autobiography he characterizes the move as a “moral disinheritance.”

Santayana had a rich early education, spending eight years at the Boston Latin School. He revealingly reflects on those early years (the fall of 1874 through 1882), in his autobiography: “…I know I was solitary and unhappy, out of humor with everything that surrounded me, and attached only to a persistent dream-life, fed on books of fiction, on architecture and on religion.” Besides Latin, students of the Boston Latin School studied Greek, Mathematics, History, French, English Composition, Literature, and Rhetoric. Through this exposure Santayana managed to develop a life-long appreciation for classical and medieval worlds and their cultural contributions, to a great extent preferring them to modern offerings. These appreciations would contribute a breadth of historical perspective to Santayana’s mature philosophical works that is unrivaled by his American contemporaries.

In his early education Santayana nurtured a love of poetry and even entertained seriously the possibility of becoming an architect. Entering Harvard upon graduation from the Latin School in 1882, Santayana respectively took his undergraduate and graduate degrees (B.A., ’86, Ph.D. ‘89), benefiting incalculably from the philosophical mentorship of his teachers, amongst whom were two of the most famous “golden age” Harvard philosophers: William James and Josiah Royce. Upon successful completion of his doctorate, Santayana, by now fully committed to the discipline, began teaching philosophy at Harvard in the fall of 1889. He would remain there until his departure at the zenith of academic success. In 1912 Santayana took advantage of a modest inheritance from the death of his mother to retire from Harvard, and left for Europe indefinitely.

As to his time in America, though he does offer the occasional fond or sympathetic reflection, Santayana largely hated academic life and commercialism and the dead Puritanism that he identified in his novel The Last Puritan. Probably referring obliquely to his own eventual feelings of exile in America, Santayana wrote: “It is natural for a man to like to live at home, and to live long elsewhere without a sense of exile is not good for his moral integrity” (Winds of Doctrine, Charles Scribner’s Sons, 1913, pg. 6).

He left the U.S. to live an intellectually free life in Oxford, Paris, and, after 1925, Rome. Unsuccessful in his efforts to leave Rome before World War II, on October 14, 1941 he entered the Clinica della Piccola Compagna di Maria, or “Convent of the Blue Nuns,” a hospital-clinic where he lived until his death in September of 1952. He is buried in the only Spanish plot in Rome’s Campo Verano Cemetery.

2. Writings

Next to Ralph Waldo Emerson, Santayana is arguably one of the best writers in the Classical American tradition. Most philosophers tend to read Santayana as a literary figure (which he is) rather than a serious philosopher (which he is also), part of which has to do with the fact that his publications strike in both directions simultaneously: an oddity from the perspective of a public that tends to quarantine the two areas of interest.

His philosophical works reflect two distinct periods, the early “humanistic” period in which he composed The Sense of Beauty (1896), Interpretations of Poetry and Religion (1900), and the five-volume The Life of Reason (1905-6); and the later “ontological” period which yielded Scepticism and Animal Faith (1923), and the four-volume ontology titled Realms of Being (between 1927 and 1940).

Santayana sometimes repudiated his earlier work, in part for its having the taint of academic life. He especially spoke down at times about the Life of Reason series for its association with the progressivism of the day, and it was later edited by Santayana and his late-life personal assistant and secretary, Daniel Cory, with the intent of removing some of its more humanistic overtones.

These authorial disparagements notwithstanding, The Life of Reason series holds up as one of the greatest philosophical works of the early half of the twentieth century. His peer and adversarial contemporary John Dewey praised the series in a review of 1907 as “the most adequate contribution America has yet made—always excepting Emerson—to moral philosophy” (John Dewey, in John Dewey: The Middle Works, Volume 4 [1907-1909], edited by Jo Ann Boydston, Southern Illinois University Press, 1977: 241). The series would have a lasting influence on naturalistic philosophy in the twentieth century.

In his budding writing career Santayana also published a volume of poetry (an 1894 collection titled Sonnets and Other Verses). Nevertheless his poetic muse would fade with the passing of years. Despite in his early years attracting a near-cult following of Harvard poets, and later maintaining the same mentorship through their Rome pilgrimages, letters, and solicitations of feedback, Santayana’s literary exertions would be restricted to fiction and philosophy.

Early in his career at Harvard, Santayana would feel the pressure to produce a work of philosophy. The Sense of Beauty (1896)—an exercise in aesthetic formalism—was culled from a series of lectures he gave between 1892 and 1893 as a newly appointed Harvard professor. The book contains the famous definition of beauty as “pleasure regarded as a quality of the thing.” To this day The Sense of Beauty is arguably the most widely read of Santayana’s philosophical corpus. This is most likely due to its restrictive scope in comparison to his other philosophical works, while there has been the tendency for Santayana’s more ambitious philosophy to be neglected. This neglect probably will subside with the ongoing MIT Press Critical Edition publications of The Works of Santayana, edited by William G. Holzberger and Herman J. Saatkamp, Jr.

After The Sense of Beauty, Santayana published Interpretations of Poetry and Religion in 1900, a work which famously provoked William James—Santayana’s then-recent colleague—to characterize his philosophy as a “perfection of rottenness.” The book also provoked a key recognition from the other of Santayana’s early influential mentors, and also dissertation advisor, Josiah Royce. Santayana relates that Royce told him around the time of Interpretations that “the gist of [his] philosophy [is] the separation of essence from existence” (“Apologia Pro Mente Sua” in The Library of Living Philosophers: The Philosophy of George Santayana, edited by Paul Arthur Schilpp, New York: Tudor Publishing, pg. 497). The ontological categories of “essence” and “matter” would become key components of Santayana’s mature philosophy. (See section 3c.)

Besides being a poet, philosopher, and novelist, Santayana was a hugely influential cultural critic. In a trenchant 1911 address before the Philosophical Union in California he coined the term “genteel tradition” and memorably provided the characterization of America as an “old wine in new bottles.” He wrote many similarly speculatively rich essays diagnosing the cultural character of the America of his time, some of which included penetrating philosophical criticisms of his contemporaries and former teachers, James and Royce. These diagnoses were early collected in the volume Character and Opinion in the United States (1920).

None of Santayana’s writings stray entirely from philosophical considerations, including his only fictional novel. Santayana authored a single best-selling work of fiction titled The Last Puritan, published in 1936. He spent several of his post-Harvard years composing the book, and many of the main characters reflect personalities close to the author. The main theme of the novel (co-titled: “Memoir in the Form of a Novel”) is of interest for its enhancing one’s understanding of Santayana’s view towards America. It chronicles the tragic, sacrificial life of Oliver Alden, the title-subject, a romantic and pious youth whose inner religious sensibilities conflict with the pulsating natural life around him. Alden is from one standpoint a sympathetic character, one with whom the author himself admitted affinities. But from another standpoint the protagonist represented the tragic contemporary American as Santayana understood him—partly in reaction to troubled young poets and artists Santayana knew from his Harvard days.

Santayana’s broader cultural criticism can be found in such works as Winds of Doctrine (1913) and the beautiful and unforced Soliloquies in England (1922), remarkably written amidst the uncertain, violent times of World War I. The latter is an exemplary instance—of which two others include Dialogues in Limbo (1926) and Platonism and the Spiritual Life (1927)—where one finds the post-Harvard Santayana following inspirations as they come, allowing both his literary imagination and penetrating philosophical eye to take equal share in the interpretive task.

These shorter works undoubtedly provided opportunities of creative release for Santayana as the ambitious project of conceiving a system of philosophy began to assert itself. In 1923 Scepticism and Animal Faith (hereafter SAF), the introductory text to his four-volume system of philosophy was published. SAF is one of the few Santayana works to have remained in print up to the present. The book introduces the terminology and critical background of his mature ontology, itself unfolded in four volumes over the period of thirteen years.

3. Philosophy

a. Ontology and Epiphenomenalism

Despite minor shifts in emphasis and Santayana’s own attitude towards his work, there is no radical break between the early humanistic Santayana, and the mature, ontological one. The same persistent distinction between ideals and natural grounds for those ideals—which he calls in his mature ontology “essence” and “matter”—holds throughout all of Santayana’s works; and the same abiding concern for reconciling moral with natural life remains intact.

As Royce had prophesied, an ontological distinction persisted throughout Santayana’s works: between “essence,” or the infinite realm of character embodiments that any existing thing must take on in order to be experienced by humans, and “existence,” or the groundless causal flux of nature that underlies any form whatsoever.

In the Life of Reason Santayana emphasizes the distinction between “perfections” or “ideals” and their “natural roots” which he sometimes calls a “natural ground” or “basis” for all action, thought and experience: “Every genuine ideal has a natural basis…Ideals are legitimate, and each initially envisages a genuine and innocent good; but they are not realizable together, nor even singly when they have no deep roots in the world.” Such ideals then are not Platonic forms, in that they have “roots” and bear the marks of their natural origins. Plato’s forms, on the contrary, are conceived as entirely foreign to natural origins.

But Santayana’s terminological shift from talking of ideals and natural grounds to talking of essence and matter perhaps did come at a certain cost. Throughout the evolution of his thinking Santayana holds to an increasing, and to many interpreters troubling, epiphenomenal view of consciousness. Briefly, epiphenomenalism is the view that mind is derivative, wholly caused, and has itself no causal power. Such strong epiphenomenalism comes out in the following passage from RB: “…the realm of matter cannot admit mind into its progressive structure and movement; each trope or rhythm must be complete before sensation can arise; so that this sensation is intrinsically a result and not a cause, a comment and not an agent…” If mind and sensation appear on the scene only as after-effects, one has to wonder how human experience can be considered fulfilling—how more specifically it can be anything but an ineffectual, spectator process.

There is however more than this to Santayana’s view of mind and accompanying story of human experience. To see this one needs a further understanding of the definitive concepts of his mature philosophy.

b. Realms and Terminology

The four realms of being Santayana identifies, in the order in which he published each RB volume, are essence, matter, truth, and spirit. The realms are said by Santayana to be “qualities of reality” (RB 183) (not themselves to be confused as parts of the cosmos), that are worth distinguishing to render human experience more fulfilling, intelligent, and edifying.

Santayana holds that the realms are irreducibly different and are for that reason worth distinguishing. The possibility that there are more realms is not something he dismisses; his only condition for an additional realm is that it be irreducibly distinct from the four he distinguishes.

As indicated, before introducing the realms individually Santayana set up their presentation through a penetrating and synthetic critical introduction, published in 1923 as Scepticism and Animal Faith. Understanding the project of SAF requires acquaintance with the meaning of key original concepts, amongst which are: “intuition,” “intent,” “psyche,” “animal faith,” and “skepticism.”

All belief, Santayana writes, is “a form of some faith in animal, material existence.” What Santayana calls “animal faith,” is the instinctive (if you will) and unavoidable tendency for human actions to betray a deep belief in the existence of matter. On Santayana’s account, one cannot act without believing in matter. According to Santayana, the denial in speech or dialectical skepticism of the existence of matter is a solipsistic, momentary pose. So philosophers like Descartes and Berkeley are transcendental posers, inflexibly denying in theory what they unhesitatingly affirm in practice. Worse yet, however: these Modern’s conflate functional orientations of the mind which Santayana respectively distinguishes as “intuition” and “intent.”

“Intuition” is for Santayana the contemplation or consciousness of an essence (more on these shortly) apart from belief in any particular existence. Santayana contrasts “intent” from intuition in order to capture the process of “taking” essences as existences. When we interact with, manipulate, engage, or otherwise encounter what we experience as physical objects, we are imbuing essences with intent—giving them a material existence they can never literally have. This process of intent is governed by the preferential makeup of what Santayana terms “psyche.”

The psyche is the material set of preferences that define individuality in organisms. The psyche is, very simply, the material manifestation of mind and as such it is imbued with, defined by, and stricken with belief. When one is believing, one is acting on behalf of one’s psyche. When one is intuiting essences without the addition of belief in their existence—be it a revery, daydream, or performative trance as in a locked moment of harmonious activity—one is communing spiritually with the realm of essence.

This raises the issue of skepticism: if we only ever have a symbolic grasp of material reality, and we can at any point imaginatively “escape” such symbolic play, what’s to keep us from relapsing into Cartesian (re)pose? The first ten chapters of SAF are an exercise in engaging Cartesianism, with the goal of pushing skepticism to its “ultimate” limits.

As a skeptic Descartes was half-hearted according to Santayana (as regards naturalism he also accused his contemporary John Dewey of this), in that he thought skepticism ceased with awareness of the self. For Santayana, nothing overcomes skepticism except pure intuition, the irony of which is the fact that pure intuition issues in the “discovery of essence,” which is itself a bankruptcy of knowledge (see “essence” below). So where Descartes had sought the most indubitable knowledge, and proceeded on the principle that such a thing could be achieved, Santayana tries to show in SAF that the principle of indubitable knowledge is itself a paradox; when knowledge is tested by way of a radical skepticism, and certainty is the ultimate goal, the paradox is that certainty is achieved only at the cost of knowledge itself. “Certainty,” for Santayana, is thus a transcendent vision of essence and as such has nothing to do with knowledge, much less with science.

So the goal of SAF is to bankrupt Cartesianism, and in doing so to suggest a new starting point for philosophy. That starting point is animal faith, the tacit acceptance of material reality as the source of understanding, knowledge, and common sense. Hence the title: “Skepticism AND Animal Faith”: we need skepticism to intellectually clear the way for, and at the same time to lead us back to, natural intelligence—to the realms themselves!

c. Realms Defined

Essence: The realm of essence should be understood to have a certain primacy since it is infinite and pertains to all of the forms or definite character embodiments that material objects and events may take on. Essence is what Santayana defines as the most radical sense in which anything is or has a character. Nothing—be it material objects, objects of thought, imaginings, flights of fancy, or objects of logical deduction—is experienced except through the mediation, or more accurately, “im-mediation” of essences. In his inimitable way, Santayana says of essences that they are “the only things people ever see and the last they notice.” Essences are said by Santayana to designate the realm of internal or intrinsic relations, and awareness of essences indicates a departure from what is called “knowledge,” which he defines as “faith mediated by symbols.” Awareness of essence is just that: awareness; it is direct and unmediated and as such entails no faith (belief in realities not given).

Matter: The catch however is that Santayana is a thoroughgoing materialist, in that he holds that no form can appear to human intuition without the previous establishment of material conditions for that form to arise. Matter is the primordial existential flux and is an unintelligible “surd.” This does not mean, however, that matter cannot be “known,” at least provisionally. Like Spinoza’s substance, existence or matter for Santayana has no purpose, but imposes external, natural limits to all activity. Those external limits define human life and mark off the boundaries between human understanding and the unfathomable depths of material existence. Santayana holds that humans know matter only at a remove, that is, (to repeat) symbolically. Matter is in fact referred to by Santayana as a “metaphor” only, producing one of the more provocative aspects of his philosophy: science is no less literary than poetry in representing matter in that it must express its truths at a remove, through the lens of human bias. In this sense Santayana’s materialism is, to use a contemporary term, “non-reductive.” Whatever scientists keep telling us of matter, while it is the hallmark of wisdom to defer everyday understanding to these experts (their findings do after all indicate a provisional advance upon previous understanding and serve contemporary sympathies very well), it is for Santayana only spiritual nearsightedness to deem such knowledge exhaustive of the cosmos.

Truth: As a fourth realm of being, truth wasn’t conceived by Santayana until after the first three (essence, matter and spirit) had been distinguished, and may therefore be justly supposed to have been introduced somewhat ad hoc. Whatever the reason, by 1913 (10 years before the publication of SAF) Santayana had conceived truth to round out his fourfold ontology. Truth is alleged by Santayana to be a subset of the infinite realm of essence. The realm of truth is the total inventory of essences instantiated by matter. The master metaphor for truth is given by Santayana in RB as: “Truth is the furrow which matter must plow upon the face of essence.” All events that take place entail concatenations of essences elected by matter for appearance in the course of human life, and their objective relations—factual arrangement, for example, that the terrorist attacks in America in 2001 took place on September 11th rather than the 12th—introduce the possibility of truth for human understanding.

Though there are similarities, Santayana’s view of truth differs in important respects from that of Classical pragmatists: truth for Santayana is fully objective and not necessarily presupposing of a cognizing agent; it is the necessary condition for the possibility of true opinions (Santayana appeals to the self-conscious act of lying as evidence of this fact); judgments are true if and only if they faithfully reproduce a portion of the descriptive properties of the process of the world coming, becoming, and going away into existence. These features of truth are guaranteed by the eternal status of the terms of its acknowledgement: essences.

Thus the pragmatist account of truth as what “works,” in the sense of what fits the current standard comprehensive description of the world is acceptable to Santayana so long as there is an understanding that the terms that make truth possible, namely, essences, are eternal, everlasting possibilities of experience that are not reducible to that experience. This is where Santayana especially departs from the pragmatist account of truth: it is not reducible to experience.

Spirit: Finally, Santayana distinguishes the realm of spirit, which is neither more nor less mysterious than one’s everyday understanding of consciousness. Santayana defines consciousness as the “total inner difference between being asleep and awake.” John Lachs has characterized Santayana’s spirit as that part of a life constituted by its series of intuitions. The native affinity of mind is, according to Santayana, to essence and not to fact. (This is an important outcome of his engagement with and overcoming of Cartesianism.) As such consciousness may play with appearances apart from the believing intent of the organic manifestation of mind (psyche); to the extent that it does so play, the spiritual life has been lived. Spirit is the ability of mind to turn natural events and experiences into appearances of themselves, and in so doing allow a healthy cosmic repose even as nature moves ceaselessly, beautifully, and sometimes destructively along.

In this way the core contribution of Santayana’s philosophy can be seen to culminate in a reconciliation of spirit and nature, two realities very much at odds in contemporary life. Santayana’s status as something of an “acquired taste” philosopher may plausibly be argued to be a function of his uncommon ability to uphold two sincere sympathies: on the one hand with Platonism and the spiritual life, and on the other with the life of reason which includes an openness to the advantages of three phases of moral life he called in that same-titled volume “pre-rational morality,” “rational ethics,” and “post-rational morality.”

4. Naturalism in World Perspective

As should not be surprising from what has been presented, Santayana consistently praises select philosophers and philosophies from history for what he considers their “naturalistic piety.” From the Ancient world, Santayana was deeply impressed with Lucretius, and also what he gleaned from Eastern Indian philosophy. Of the Modern philosophers, Santayana reserves his highest praise for Spinoza.

Backed by these historical allies, Santayana provides in a soliloquy a memorable (if partly irreverent) arrangement of world-philosophies:

…the progress of philosophy has not been of such a sort that the latest philosophers are the best: it is quite the other way…the later we come down in the history of philosophy the less important philosophy becomes, and the less true in fundamental matters.
Suppose I arrange the works of the essential philosophers—leaving out secondary and transitional systems—in a bookcase of four shelves; on the top shelf (out of reach since I can’t read the language) I will place the Indians; on the next the Greek naturalists; and to remedy the unfortunate paucity of their remains, I will add here those free inquirers of the renaissance, leading to Spinoza, who after two thousand years picked up the thread of scientific speculation; and besides, all modern science: so that this shelf will run over into a whole library of what is not ordinarily called philosophy. On the third shelf I will put Platonism, including Aristotle, the Fathers, the Scholastics, and all honestly Christian theology; and on the last, modern or subjective philosophy in its entirety. I will leave lying on the table, as of doubtful destination, the works of my contemporaries. There is much life in some of them. I like their water-colour sketches of self-consciousness, their rebellious egotisms, their fervid reforms of phraseology, their peep-holes through which some very small part of things may be seen very clearly: they have lively wits, but they seem to me like children playing blind-man’s-buff; they are keenly excited at not knowing where they are. (“The Progress of Philosophy,” in Soliloquies in England and Later Soliloquies, Charles Scribner’s Sons, 1922: 208-210)

Santayana recommends placing on the bottom, “inferior” shelves all the philosophy that is published, reprinted, and discussed in universities across the Western world today. This recommendation motivated one critic to characterize Santayana as a “defiant eclectic” (Charles Hartshorne, “Santayana’s Defiant Eclecticism” in The Journal of Philosophy, Vol. LXI. No. 1, 1964: 35-44), suggesting that his thinking amounts to a high-minded circumvention of the real problems of philosophy through the sublimation of a few eccentric doctrines. This point is still an issue among Santayana scholars. What is clear is that Santayana combined an indisputably rich reading of the history of philosophy with an unparalleled synoptic critical vision.

5. Legacy

Santayana’s philosophy has had a modest, unsettled legacy, one which nevertheless surprises in its continuing ability to attract sensibilities from across academic disciplines. While his thinking never has, and likely never will be, given to indoctrination or discipleship, it is clear that Santayana never conceived of these as important and justifiably suspected that such things were bad rather than good indications that a philosophy is worthy of the world it struggles to understand.

Still, a glowing campfire of devotion to Santayana’s work persists, first through the institutional support of the MIT Press and the staff of the Santayana Edition at Indiana University-Purdue University Indianapolis (IUPUI); and second from the scholarly contributions made to the only Santayana journal, Overheard in Seville: Bulletin of the Santayana Society. The Bulletin is published annually and is edited by Angus Kerr-Lawson. The Santayana Society meets annually in December at the Eastern gathering of the American Philosophical Association and has recently been added to the proceedings of the annual meetings of the Society for the Advancement of American Philosophy. MIT Press is in the process of publishing a critical edition of The Works of George Santayana, several of which are currently released.

The future of Santayana studies, whatever their course, will depend upon genuine interest in a non-reductive philosophical naturalism that expresses deep respect to religious sensibilities and leads the charge for the return to a conception of philosophy as a way of life rather than as a critical profession with little relevance to inner experience.

6. References and Further Reading

a. MIT Press Critical Editions

All works by George Santayana are undergoing republication as critical editions through MIT Press, under the editorship of William G. Holzberger and Herman J. Saatkamp, Jr., and the editorial work of those affiliated with the Santayana Edition at Indiana University-Purdue University Indianapolis.

Persons and Places (1987).
The Sense of Beauty (1988).
Interpretations of Poetry and Religion (1990).
The Last Puritan (1994).
The Letters of George Santayana: Books I-VIII (2001-2008).

b. Other Santayana Works

Animal Faith and Spiritual Life. Edited by John Lachs. New York: Appleton-Century- Crofts, 1967.
The Birth of Reason and Other Essays. Daniel Cory, editor. New York and London: Columbia University Press, 1968.
Character and Opinion in the United States. New York, Charles Scribner’s Sons: 1921.
Dialogues in Limbo. The University of Michigan Press, 1948.
Dominations and Powers: Reflections on Liberty, Society, and Government. New York, Charles Scribner’s Sons: 1951.
Egotism in German Philosophy. Charles Scribner’s Sons, 1940.
Essays in Literary Criticism. Edited by Irving Singer. New York, Charles Scribner’s Sons: 1956.
The Genteel Tradition: Nine Essays by George Santayana. Lincoln and London: The University of Nebraska Press, 1967.
The Idea of Christ in the Gospels. New York, Charles Scribner’s Sons: 1946.
Life of Reason or The Phases of Human Progress, One Volume Edition. New York: Charles Scribner’s Sons, 1955.
Obiter Scripta. New York, Charles Scribner’s Sons: 1936.
The Philosophy of Santayana. Edited by Irwin Edman. The Modern Library, 1936.
Poems. New York, Charles Scribner’s Sons: 1923.
The Realms of Being. New York, Charles Scribner’s Sons: 1942.
Santayana on America: Essays, Notes, and Letters on American Life, Literature, and Philosophy. Edited by Richard Colton Lyon. New York: Harcourt, Brace & World, Inc., 1968.
Scepticism and Animal Faith. New York: Dover Publications, 1923, 1955.
Soliloquies in England and Later Soliloquies. New York, Charles Scribner’s Sons: 1922.
Some Turns of Thought in Modern Philosophy. New York, Charles Scribner’s Sons: 1933.
Winds of Doctrine: Studies in Contemporary Opinion. New York, Charles Scribner’s Sons: 1913.

c. Books About Santayana

Ames, Van Meter. Proust and Santayana: The Aesthetic Way of Life. New York: Willett, Clark & Company, 1937.
Arnett, Willard E. Santayana and the Sense of Beauty. Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1957.
Butler, Richard. The Life and World of George Santayana. Chicago: A Gateway Edition, 1960.
Coleman, Martin; Santayana Edition (IUPUI). The Essential Santayana: Selected Writings. Compiled with an introduction by Martin Coleman and the Santayana Edition at IUPUI. Indiana University Press, 2009.
Cory, Daniel. The Letters of George Santayana. New York, Charles Scribner’s Sons: 1955.
Cory, Daniel. Santayana: The Later Years; A Portrait With Letters. New York: George Braziller, 1963.
Flamm, Matthew Caleb and Krzysztof Piotr Skowronski. Under Any Sky: Contemporary Readings of George Santayana. Newcastle: Cambridge Scholars Publishing, 2007.
Howgate, George W. George Santayana. New York: A.S. Barnes and Co., Inc., 1961.
Lachs, John. On Santayana. Wadsworth, 2000.
Lachs, John with Michael Hodges. Thinking in the Ruins: Wittgenstein and Santayana on Contingency. Vanderbilt University Press, 2000.
Levinson, Henry Samuel. Santayana, Pragmatism, and the Spiritual Life. Chapel Hill and London: The University of North Carolina Press: 1992.
Lamont, Corliss, editor. Dialogue on George Santayana. New York: Horizon Press, 1959.
Munson, Thomas N. The Essential Wisdom of George Santayana. New York: Columbia University Press, 1962.
Schilpp, Paul Arthur, editor. The Library of Living Philosophers: The Philosophy of George Santayana. New York: Tudor Publishing Company, 1951.
Singer, Irving. George Santayana, Literary Philosopher. Yale University Press, 2000.
Sprigge, Timothy. Santayana. London and New York: Routledge, 1995.
Woodward, Anthony. Living in the Eternal: A Study of George Santayana. Nashville: Vanderbilt University Press, 1988.

Author Information

Matthew Caleb Flamm
Email: mflamm@rockford.edu
Rockford College
U. S. A.

Gorgias (483—375 B.C.E.)

Gorgias was a Sicilian philosopher, orator, and rhetorician. He is considered by many scholars to be one of the founders of sophism, a movement traditionally associated with philosophy, that emphasizes the practical application of rhetoric toward civic and political life. The sophists were itinerant teachers who accepted fees in return for instruction in oratory and rhetoric, and many claimed they could teach anything and its opposite (thesis and antithesis). Another aspect of their method was the ability to make the weaker argument the stronger. The term sophist in classical Greek was a general appellation denoting a “wise man.” They were important figures in Greece in the 4th and 5th centuries, and their social success was great. Plato was the first to use the term rhêtorikê, while the sophists termed their “art” logos . Nevertheless, Gorgias is commonly associated with the development of rhetoric in classical Greece. The democratic process in Athens supplied the need for instruction in both rhetoric and philosophy.

Despite efforts by G.W.F Hegel and George Grote toward rehabilitating the reputations of Gorgias and the other sophists in the 19th century, the sophists still had a foul reputation well into the 20th century (as evidenced by the pejorative term “sophistry”). In 1930, French philosopher Jacques Maritain remarked “[s]ophistry is not a system of ideas, but a vicious attitude of the mind;” the sophists “came to consider as the most desirable form of knowledge the art of refuting and disproving by skillful arguments” (32-33). In recent years, however, modernists and post-structuralists have found great value in the philosophy of Gorgias, especially his theories on truth and language.

Life and Works
Philosophy
1. Ontology & Epistemology
2. Rhetorical Theory
Critics
References and Further Reading

1. Life and Works

Gorgias (483-375 B.C.E.) came to Greece from Leontini in Sicily. Little is known of his life before he arrived in Athens in 427 B.C.E. as a political ambassador seeking military assistance against Syracuse, a city-state in Sicily. He delivered a series of speeches that dazzled the Athenian audiences and won him fame and admiration. Upon completion of his mission, he traveled throughout Greece as a teacher of rhetoric and as an orator, and according to Aristotle, spoke at the Panhellenic festivals (Art of Rhetoric 1414b29). He was a student of Empedocles, and according to Quintilian and others, was the teacher of Isocrates. Plato identifies Meno (Meno 76Aff) among the students of Gorgias, and he may have been one of Aspasia’s instructors as well. Many of the sophists set up schools and charged fees in return for instruction in rhetoric, and Gorgias was no exception. Philostratus (Lives of the Sophists I 9, I) tells us that Gorgias began the practice of extemporaneous oratory, and that he had the boldness to say “‘suggest a subject’ …he was the first to proclaim himself willing to take the chance, showing apparently that he knew everything and would trust the moment to speak on any subject.” He died at the age of 108 at Larissa in Thessaly.

Four works are attributed to Gorgias: On the Nonexistent or On Nature, the Apology of Palamedes, the Encomium on Helen, and the Epitaphios or Athenian Funeral Oration. The original text of On Nature has been lost, and survives only in two different paraphrases, one in Sextus Empiricus’ Against the Professors and another in an anonymous work entitled Melissus, Xenophanes, Gorgias. There are two different manuscripts of Palamedes and Helen (the Cripps and Palatine versions), one slightly different than the other. Legal historians consider the Defense of Palamedes to be an important contribution to dicanic [explanatory] argumentation, and some cultural historians believe the Epitaphios was used as a stylistic and genre source for Plato’s Menexenus (Cosigny 2). Gorgias’ rhyming style is highly poetic, and he viewed the orator as an individual leading a kind of group incantation. He employs metaphor and figurative expressions to illustrate his assertions, and even uses humor as one instrument of refutation. The term macrologia (using more words than necessary in an effort to appear eloquent) is sometimes used to describe his oratorical technique (Kennedy 63).

2. Philosophy

Any student of Gorgias must immediately mark the distinction between his philosophy as expressed by Plato in the dialogue Gorgias (see below) and his philosophy found within the three works: On the Nonexistent, the Apology of Palamedes, and the Encomium on Helen.

a. Ontology & Epistemology

Nowhere is Gorgias’ sophistical love of paradox more evident than in the short treatise On the Nonexistent or On Nature. The subject of this work is ontological (concerning nature of being), but it also deals with language and epistemology (the study of the nature and limitations of knowledge). In addition to this, it can be understood as an exercise in sophistical rhetoric; Gorgias tackles an argument that is seemingly impossible to refute, namely that, after considering our world, we must come to the conclusion that “things exist.” His powerful argument to the contrary proves his abilities as a master of oratory, and some believe the text was used as an advertisement of his credentials.

Gorgias begins his argument by presenting a logical contradiction, “if the nonexistent exists, it will both exist and not exist at the same time” (B3.67) (a violation of the principle of non-contradiction). He then denies that existence (to on) itself exists, for if it exists, it is either eternal or generated. If it is eternal, it has no beginning, and is therefore without limit. If it is without limit, it is “nowhere” (B3.69), and hence does not exist. And if existence is generated, it must come from something, and that something is existence, which is another contradiction. Likewise, nonexistence (to mê on) cannot produce anything (B3.71). The sophist then explains that existence can neither be “one” (hen) or “many” (polla), since if it were one, it would be divisible, and therefore not one. If it were many, it would be a “composite of separate entities” (B3.74) and no longer the thing known as existence.

Gorgias then turns his attention to what is knowable and comprehensible. He remarks, “if things considered [imagined or thought] in the mind are not existent, the existent is not considered” (B3.77), that is to say, existence is incomprehensible. This supposition is backed up by the fact that one can imagine chariots racing in the sea, but that does not make such a thing happen. The operation of the mind (intellection) is fundamentally distinct from what happens in the real world; “the existent is not an object of consideration and is not apprehended” (B3.82). It is helpful to think of apprehension here in Aristotelian terms, as simple apprehension, the first operation of reasoning (logic) in which the intellect “grasps” or “apprehends” something. Simple apprehension happens when the mind first forms a concept of something in the world, and is anterior to judgment.

Finally, Gorgias proclaims that even if existence could be apprehended, “it would be incapable of being conveyed to another” (B3.83). This is because what we reveal to another is not an external substance, but is merely logos (from the Greek verb lego, “to say”–see below). Logos is not “substances and existing things” (B3.84). External reality becomes the revealer of logos (B3.85); while we can know logos, we cannot apprehend things directly. The color white, for instance, goes from a property of a thing, to a mental representation, and the representation is different than the thing itself. In its summation, this nihilistic argument becomes a “trilemma”:

i. Nothing exists
ii. Even if existence exists, it cannot be known
iii. Even if it could be known, it cannot be communicated.

This argument has led some to label Gorgias as either an ontological skeptic or a nihilist (one who believes nothing exists, or that the world is incomprehensible, and that the concept of truth is fictitious). But it can also be interpreted as an assertion that it is logos and logos alone which is the proper object of our inquiries, since it is the only thing we can really know. On Nature is sometimes seen as a refutation of pre-Socratic essentialist philosophy (McComiskey 37).

b. Rhetorical Theory

Most of what we know concerning Gorgias’ views on rhetoric comes from the Encomium. This work can be understood as a sophistical effort to rehabilitate the reputation of Helen of Troy. In it, Gorgias attempts to take the weaker argument and make it the stronger one, by arguing for a position contrary to well-established opinion: in this case, the opinion that Helen was to blame for the Trojan War. Gorgias argues that Helen succumbed either to (a) physical force (Paris’ abduction), (b) love (eros), or (c) verbal persuasion (logos), and in any instance, she cannot be blamed for her actions. According to Gorgias, logos is a powerful force that can be used nefariously to convince people to do things against their own interests. It can take the form of poetry (metrical language), divine incantations, or oratory. Logos is described as a “powerful lord” (B11.8) and “[t]he effect of speech upon the condition of the soul is comparable to the power of drugs over the nurture of bodies” (B11.14). This should be contrasted with the view of Isocrates that logos is a “chief” or “commander” (Nicoles 5-9). The difference here is subtle, but Gorgias’ dynastic concept of logos clearly turns it into a despotic overlord, while Isocrates’ “commander” is a leader with delegated authority, an individual who fights along side his troops.

Examples of persuasive speech, according to Gorgias, are the “conflicts among the philosophers’ arguments in which the swiftness of demonstration and judgment make the belief in any opinion changeable” (B11.13). This is similar to the assertion of Sextus Empiricus that equally convincing arguments can be formed against, or in favor of, any subject. Gorgias may have believed in a relative notion of truth that was contingent upon a particular kairos (an opportune moment or “opening”), that is to say, truth can only be found within a given moment. He seems to reject the idea of truth as a philosophically universal principle, and thus comes into conflict with Plato and Aristotle. Nevertheless, the rhetor (orator) is ethically obligated to avoid deception, and it is “the duty of the same man both to declare what he should rightly and to refute what has been spoken falsely” (B11.2). Ultimately, Gorgias’ opinion concerning truth is difficult to ascertain, but from his writings, we can conclude that he was more concerned with rhetorical argument than the truth of any given proposition or assertion.

In the epideictic speech Defense of Palamedes, Gorgias uses a mythical narrator (Palamedes) to further illustrate his rhetorical technique and philosophy. In the Odyssey, Palamedes was responsible for revealing Odysseus’ “madness” as a fiction, an act for which the latter never forgave him. Ultimately, Palamedes was executed for treason, after Odysseus accused him of conspiring with the Trojans. Gorgias focuses on the invention of arguments (topoi) necessary to exonerate Palamedes within the setting of a fictional trial, all of which depend upon probability. Palamedes could not have committed treason with a foreign power since he speaks no language other than Greek (B11a.6-7), and no Greek desires social power among barbarians (B11a.13). In the second example, we see that topoi “embody the values of the community, in the sense that they comprise what the community considers important” (Cosigny 84). A fundamental difference between the topoi found within Aristotle’s Art of Rhetoric and Gorgias’ topoi is that Aristotle’s are “acontextual, while Gorgias places his in the narrative context of the Palamedes myth” (McComiskey 49). Therefore, there is a direct relationship between kairos and invention.

Gorgias rejects the use of pathos (emotional appeal) in his Defense, with the assertion that “among you, who are the foremost of the Greeks …there is no need to persuade such ones as you with the aid of friends and sorrowful prayers and lamentations” (B11a.33). He prefers to use ethos (ethical appeal, or arguments from character) and logos, as his instruments of persuasion.

3. Critics

Gorgias’ most famous critic is Plato. In the dialogue Gorgias, Plato (through his mentor Socrates) expresses his contempt for sophistical rhetoric; all rhetoric is “a phantom of a branch of statesmanship (463d) …a kind of flattery …that is contemptible,” because its aim is simply pleasure rather than the welfare of the public. Nor can rhetoric be considered an art (technê), since it is irrational (465a). The end result of rhetoric is a cosmetic alteration of language that conceals truth and falsity (465b). Furthermore, rhetoric is “designed to produce conviction, but not educate people, about matters of right or wrong (455a). The character of Gorgias in the dialogue is forced to admit that his “art” deals with opinion (doxa) rather than knowledge (epistemê); that its intention is to persuade rather than to instruct, and that rhetoric deals with language without regard to content. Gorgias is portrayed as a man with an ambivalent attitude towards truth, a relativist, who boldly asserts that it does not matter if one truly has knowledge of any given subject, only that he is perceived by others to have knowledge, and that “[r]hetoric is the only area of expertise you need to learn. You can ignore all the rest and still get the better of the professionals!” (459c).

There are a number of explanations for Plato’s antipathy towards sophistic rhetoric. The first is simply philosophical; Plato was not a relativist, nor did he believe rhetoric had a pedagogical value. But there is also a political element to be considered. Bruce McComiskey points out that Plato believed in an “oligarchic government” for Athens, while many of the sophists “favored the Athenian Democracy the way it was” (20). It is important to point out that during Gorgias’ lifetime, both Leontini and Athens were democratic city states and a loose alliance existed between the two. On a more practical level, the Greek city states also served as a market for those who would sell instruction in rhetoric.

Aristotle dismisses Gorgias as a “frigid” stylist who indulges in excessive use of compound words such as “begging-poet-flatterers” and “foresworn and well-sworn” (Art of Rhetoric 1405b34). He also faults Gorgias for overly poetic language (1406b4), and we can see examples of this in Gorgias’ description of logos as a great dynast or lord (B11.8) and as a “drug” (B11.14). The sophist compares orators to “frogs croaking in water”(B3.30), and philosophers to the “suitors of Penelope” (B3.29).

4. References and Further Reading

Note: the citations above regarding Gorgias’ statements follow the alpha-numeric system used by Sprague (see below) in the text The Older Sophists (B3=On Non-Being, B11=Encomium on Helen, B11a=Defense of Palamedes).

Aristotle. The Art of Rhetoric. Trans. John Henry Freese. London: WM Heinemann, 1967.
Barrett, Harold. The Sophists: Rhetoric, Democracy, and Plato’s Idea of Sophistry. Novata: Chandler & Sharp, 1987.
Consigny, Scott. Gorgias: Sophist and Artist. Columbia: University of South Carolina, 2001.
Freeman, Kathleen. Ancilla to the Pre-Socratic Philosophers. Cambridge: Harvard, 1948.
Gorgias. Encomium of Helen. Trans. Douglas MacDowell. Glasgow: Bristol Classics, 1982.
Isocrates. Isocrates. 3 vols. Trans. George Norlin and LaRue Van Hook. Cambridge: Harvard, 1968.
Jarratt, Susan. “The First Sophists and the Uses of History.” Rhetoric Review 6 (1987): 67-77.
Jarratt, Susan C. Rereading the Sophists: Classical Rhetoric Refigured . Carbondale and Edwardsville: Southern Illinois University Press, 1991.
Kennedy, George. The Art of Persuasion in Greece. Princeton N.J.: Princeton University, 1963.
Kerferd, G.B. “The First Greek Sophists.” Classical Review 64 (1950): 8-10.
Marias, Julian. History of Philosophy. New York: Dover, 1967.
Maritain, Jacques. Introduction to Philosophy. Westminster MD: Christian Classics, 1991.
McComiskey, Bruce. Gorgias and the New Sophistic Rhetoric. Carbondale: Southern Illinois, 2002.
Plato. Gorgias. Trans. Robin Waterfield. Oxford: Oxford, 1994.
Poulakos, John. Sophistical Rhetoric in Classical Greece. Columbia: University Of South Carolina, 1995.
Schiappa, Edward. “Sophistic Rhetoric: Oasis or Mirage?” Rhetoric Review 10 (1991):5-18.
Sprague, Rosamund Kent, ed. The Older Sophists. Columbia: University of South Carolina, 1972.

Author Information

C. Francis Higgins
Email: colin@louisiana.edu
University of Louisiana Lafayette
U. S. A.

Huineng (Hui-neng) (638—713)

Huineng (Hui-neng) a seminal figure in Buddhist history. He is the famous “Sixth Patriarch” of the Chan or meditation tradition, which is better known in Japanese as “Zen”). The focus of an immense body of lore that grew over the centuries, Huineng’s life mirrors the fortunes of Chan itself – a provincial Chinese version of Buddhism that rose to become a major religious and cultural force throughout East Asia. Tradition holds that Huineng was an uncouth “barbarian” youth who, because of his innate intuitive insight, surpassed his more cultured fellow monks to earn the official “dharma seal” certifying the authoritative transmission of Buddhist enlightenment, and thereby earning a lasting place in history. He is intimately associated with the Platform Sutra of the Sixth Patriarch, one of the most influential texts in all of Chinese Buddhism. Alleged to be a sermon from the lips of Huineng himself, this text provides a gripping first person account of the Master’s life. Its cryptic, yet insightful, discussion of Chan practice lays out the central concerns of Chan cultivation. Huineng’s discussion of the themes of inherent enlightenment, sudden awakening, and the non-dual nature of wisdom (Sanskrit: prajna) and meditation (Sanskrit: dhyana) resounds through later generations of Chan teachers, and continues to pose difficult philosophical challenges to this day.

Chan Buddhism in Context
Biography
Historical Issues and Mythic Elements
Central Teachings
1. Major Themes
2. Teaching Style
Influences
Critical Issues
Impact on Later Buddhist and Chinese Philosophical Traditions
References and Further Reading

1. Chan Buddhism in Context

It is impossible to disentangle Huineng from the story of early Chan. Indeed, it is in sections 49-51 of the Platform Sutra that Huineng lays out the classic story of Chan’s origins. According to this account, Chan began with the historical Buddha, Sakyamuni, and his famous “Flower Sermon.” One day the Buddha took his seat before his assembled monks and, instead of speaking, remained silent while holding a single flower aloft in his hand. Of those assembled, only one disciple Mahakashyapa (Sanskrit: “Great Kashyapa”), understood the meaning of the Buddha’s actions. The Buddha publicly recognized Mahakashyapa’s realization and he, in turn, passed the wordless teaching along to his disciples. Eventually the transmission passed to a certain Bodhidharma (c. 470-553 CE), the infamous “First Patriarch,” who, it is said, brought Chan to southern China, crossing the Yangzi (Yangtze) River on a reed. Recent scholarship has established that a mysterious figure named Bodhidharma was indeed in southern China in the fifth century proclaiming teachings based on the Lankavatara Sutra as well as a simplified but powerful form of dhyana. After his death his disciples carried on his teachings, but most of them never founded lasting lineages. Eventually these teachings were transmitted to Hongren (600-674), the Fifth Patriarch, who taught at Dongshan. Hongren had a number of disciples who spread out through China, establishing their own schools where they taught their own versions of Chan. Some died out but a few flourished, going on to record their histories to establish their particular pedigrees.

Often dubbed “the meditation school,” Chan derives its name from the Chinese term channa, an attempted transliteration of the Sanskrit term dhyana (meditation, concentration). In Japan, it is known as Zen; in Korea, as Son; and in Vietnam, as Thien. In India, dhyana encompassed a wide variety of techniques for training the mind to attain the deep insight into reality necessary for awakening. When Buddhism began making inroads into China in the first and second centuries CE, missionaries brought these techniques with them. Dhyana study proved popular in some circles – in part because of its resemblance to Daoist meditation practices – but it was just one practice alongside of others, such as sutra study, devotional rituals and the performance of charitable works. Only later did Chan become a self-conscious movement with a firm institutional base.

By the sixth century, certain monasteries in the mountainous areas of central and southwestern China became known as places reserved for intense meditation training. The masters at these centers taught methods so powerful that it was rumored that those willing to persevere could awaken in this very life. As time went on several of these meditation masters gained loyal followings and tales of them spread as their disciples established their own monasteries. It was out of this context that Chan as a distinct school (zong, “lineage”) and the legend of its most famous master arose. Modern scholars now agree that many of the stories surrounding Huineng are “mythical” reconstructions and elaborations by later generations of Chan writers. Nonetheless, this mythology tells us a lot about how Chan came to conceive itself as a distinct tradition, at once radically innovative and deeply conservative. This Chan self-conception finds its best articulation in a poem attributed to Bodhidharma, according to which Chan is “a separate transmission outside the scriptures, not relying on words and phrases, directly transmitted from mind to mind.” Such transmission can only occur within the relationship between Master and student; hence, the Master, and the connection to him, is of paramount importance in all Chan schools.

2. Biography

As with many legendary figures, it is difficult to sort fact from fiction when it comes to Huineng. We have many sources of information on him but most were written long after his lifetime. Most scholars of Buddhism now consider the story of Huineng’s life and his role in establishing Chan as a direct line going back to Sakyamuni (the historical Buddha, ca. 6th to 5th centuries BCE) to be little more than pious fiction. While there may be a kernel of historical truth to them, all of the accounts of Huineng’s life (particularly as recorded in the Platform Sutra of the Sixth Patriarch) show evidence of later expansion and elaboration. In fact, scholars cannot even agree on the location of Dafan, the temple in which Huineng allegedly recited the Platform Sutra.

The earliest mention of Huineng comes from an inscription for a memorial pagoda in Faxing monastery dated 676. The pagoda was said to commemorate Huineng’s meeting with master Yinzong (627-713), a devotee of the Nirvana Sutra and a renowned master of monastic discipline (vinaya), and the ceremony in which Huineng underwent monastic tonsure, that is, shaving of part of the head. Unfortunately, the actual inscription has not been preserved and so many historians deem it unreliable. The only other record dating back to Huineng’s lifetime just lists him as a student of the Chan master Hongren (Hong-jen).

Later records, of which there are many, probably bear little resemblance to real historical events, and actually contradict each other on certain details. Later traditions concerning Huineng vary tremendously. He seems to go into hiding for several years only to reappear in Nanhai at a monastery presided over by Yinzong. One day after the Master had finished a lecture, Huineng overheard two monks arguing over whether the temple flag or the wind was moving. Huineng abruptly injected himself into this discussion, declaring that in fact it was mind that was moving. Hearing of this, Yinzong sent for Huineng and, bowing to him, asked to be taught the dharma of Hongren. It was Yinzong who oversaw the giving of the tonsure to Huineng, the incident memorialized in the inscription mentioned above. Eventually most accounts of Huineng’s life have him retiring to the Baolin temple. Some traditions speak of Huineng being summoned to the imperial capital by the emperor Zhongzong or possibly the empress Wu Zhao (ca. 625-706). In any case, Huineng declined, preferring to spend his days in the mountains and forests preaching the dharma. He did, however, give the imperial envoy a dharma talk that jolted the messenger into an intense sudden realization. Returning to the capital the envoy reported his experience to the emperor who issued an edict praising Huineng and bestowing special gifts upon him.

Our major source for information on Huineng is the autobiographical portion (sections 2-11) of the Platform Sutra of the Sixth Patriarch, an immensely complicated text that has undergone numerous revisions over the centuries. Purporting to be a series of sermons delivered by Huineng from a high seat in the lecture hall (the “platform” alluded to in the title) of Dafan Temple, this text remains the only Chinese Buddhist discourse to be accorded sutra (Sanskrit: “scriptural”) status. The earliest extant copy of this sutra, found in a cache of writings discovered in the Dunhuang (Tun-huang) caves in northwestern China, dates to around 850 but it is corrupt and full of errors – probably the result of being copied from an earlier version by a semiliterate scribe. The first section of the text names Fahai, a student of Huineng’s, as transcribing the sermon at the behest of the district governor. Elsewhere the text names Fahai as one of the Master’s ten disciples and “chief monk” of the community. However, Fahai does not appear anywhere else in Chan literature and his exact identity remains unknown. Some scholars suggest the sutra was actually written by a later Chan monk from a different school (possibly the Niutou or “Ox-head” school) around the year 780.

While most scholars do not put much stock in either the Platform Sutra or the other sources on Huineng’s life, we can still use them to piece together something of a biography for him. It seems his family name was Lu and his father had been a minor official who was banished to the provinces where he died when his son was only three. His mother took him to southern China and raised him in extreme poverty. Huineng worked throughout his childhood to support his family by cutting wood. One day when he was a young man, he overheard a man reciting a phrase from the Diamond Sutra and at once he experienced an initial awakening. With his mother’s permission he left home and devoted himself to religious life.

Huineng spent his next years wandering, ending up with a Buddhist nun who was devoted to the Nirvana Sutra. After reciting passages from it one day she asked him to take a turn reading it aloud only to find that he was illiterate. Incredulous, she asked how he intended to learn Buddha’s truth if he could not read the sutras. The youth replied that the nature of Buddha does not depend on words and letters so what need was there to read texts? Amazed at his insight, she suggested he take up monastic life. At this point he declined, but went on to train under a meditation master.

After three years of meditating in a mountain cave, Huineng went to Dongshan (East Mountain) monastery in Hubei, where he met Master Hongren, the “Fifth Patriarch.” Glaring at this supplicant, Hongren asked where he was from and why he was there. Huineng answered simply that he was from the south and had come to learn the dharma (Buddhist doctrine) from him. Hongren retorted that as a southerner, Huineng was a mere “barbarian,” adding, “How could you become Buddha?” Unfazed by the insult, Huineng replied, “Although my ‘barbarian’ body and yours differ, what difference is there in our buddha-nature?” Realizing at once the potential of this coarse youth, Hongren resolved to test him further. He took him in but assigned him to the threshing room, where he labored for nine months, treading the mill to separate the rice grains from their husks.

The most famous incident in Huineng’s story concerns a dharma contest. One day Hongren challenged his charges to each write a verse (gatha) distilling their understanding of their “original natures.” He promised to read them and award his robe (a symbol of dharma transmission; some versions of the story include Hongren’s begging bowl) and the title “Sixth Patriarch” to the student demonstrating true realization. The task quickly devolved onto the shoulders of the head monk, Shenxiu, who, it was assumed, would be the Master’s likely successor. Shenxiu, however, was full of doubt and spent a tortured night considering his options. Finally he stole out and wrote his verse anonymously on the wall of the new dharma hall:

The body is the bodhi tree.
The heart-mind is like a mirror.
Moment by moment wipe and polish it,
Not allowing dust to collect. (section 6)

A straightforward articulation of the necessity of diligent practice, Shenxiu hoped this verse would show the Master that his students had at least some understanding.

The next morning Hongren read the verse and praised it before the community. He burned incense before it and ordered them all to recite it before calling Shenxiu for an interview. In private he commended Shenxiu for his insight, stating that the verse showed he had reached the “gates of wisdom” but had yet to enter. He then suggested Shenxiu take a few more days to compose another verse worthy of being awarded the robe.

Meanwhile, Huineng was still working in the threshing room when a novice wandered by reciting Shenxiu’s verse. Immediately Huineng realized the author of the verse lacked full understanding. Venturing out to the dharma hall, he got someone to write his reply:

Bodhi originally has no tree.
The clear and bright mirror also has no support.
Buddha-nature is constantly purifying and clearing.
Where could there be dust? (section 8)

Very soon word of this new verse spread and eventually the news reached Hongren. The Master came to read it and immediately recognized it as the work of Huineng and that this unknown prodigy was truly enlightened. However, he knew that passing his robe to an uncouth peasant would upset the monastic hierarchy. Therefore he publicly dismissed it as “not complete understanding.” Later, under cover of darkness, Hongren summoned Huineng for a secret audience in which he gave him further teachings. Passing on his robe, the Master admonished him to flee for his life, predicting, however, that eventually he would transmit the teachings. With that, Huineng fled south. After some months, Huineng was traced to a mountain by a band of pursuers intent on killing him and stealing the robe. Most of the pursuers turned back after climbing only halfway but one, Huiming (a former general) reached him on the summit. There, rather than slay the young master, he received the teaching and became enlightened. Thus being recognized as a true Chan Master, Huineng dispatched his new disciple to the north to spread the dharma and convert the populace.

One of the most colorful episodes in Huineng lore concerns his confrontation with a dragon that lived in a pond in front of Baolin temple. The dragon was particularly large and fierce, emerging regularly from the watery depths to create havoc and instill fear in the populace. Fearlessly, the Master taunted the beast for its weakness at only being unable to appear in a large as opposed to smaller form. At once the dragon disappeared only to re-emerge in small form and so show the monk his powers. Unimpressed, the Master challenged the monster to show its courage by entering his bowl. When it did so, the Master quickly scooped the dragon up, took him into the Buddha Hall, and preached dharma to it until it shed its body and departed.

Much as with other great religious figures, so the stories of Huineng’s death are particularly dramatic. The Platform Sutra gives a confused account that may combine several different versions. In essence, however, it records that as he neared his death, the Master called his disciples for a final teaching in the form of a “dharma verse.” All the disciples broke into tears over the imminent departure of their beloved teacher except for one, Shenhui, whom the Master praised for having attained the status of awakening. Chiding the others for the foolishness of their tears, Huineng told them, “All of you sit down. I shall give you a verse, the verse of the true-false moving-quiet. All of you recite it, and if you understand the meaning, you will be the same as I. If you practice with it, you will not lose the essence of the teaching.” (section 48) After this final lesson (during which he outlined the Chan lineage back to the Buddha) Huineng died at the stroke of midnight on August 28, 713. Other traditions, however, have Huineng dying in deep meditation after finishing his last meal. His passing was marked by all manner of cosmic signs: a strange perfume pervading the temple for days, mysterious bright lights, a miraculous rainbow in the sky etc. The Platform Sutra says, “Mountains crumbled, the earth trembled, and the forest trees turned white. The sun and moon ceased to shine and the wind and clouds lost their colors.” (section 54) An inscription by the poet Wang Wei (d. 759) adds “the birds and monkeys cried in anguish.”

Several posthumous stories of Huineng attest to the powerful spell he cast on later generations. Some decades after his passing the emperor sent an envoy to ask for his robe and bowl so that the court might pay them homage. These were sent back with great ceremony a few years later by the succeeding emperor, who purportedly dreamt Huineng asked that they be returned. Later, in 816, Huineng was awarded the official title “Dhyana Master Dajian” (Great Mirror). To this day there is a mummy reputed to be Huineng in the Nanhua monastery located in Caoxi. For centuries it was the focus of intense devotion, and at times was brought to the nearby city of Shanzhou to promote prosperity or ward off plagues and droughts. The mummy was also threatened several times and at least one time was nearly decapitated by rival monks seeking to gain power through possession of the Sixth Patriarch’s head.

3. Historical Issues and Mythic Elements

Historical complexities aside, however, it is the mythic dimensions of Huineng’s story that most excite the imagination. Certainly the traditional account is replete with symbolism and allusion. As a boy Huineng is the quintessential simpleton (cf. the Daoist notion of pu, “simplicity” or “the uncarved block” spoken of in Daode jing 15, 19, 28, 32, 37, 57), an illiterate peasant who, pure and unspoiled by the sophistication of his more educated fellows, serves as the perfect vessel for receiving the sacred wisdom that, in turn, flows through him to posterity. Aside from the allusions to Daode jing just noted, Huineng epitomizes the ideal found in Daode jing 70, “The sage goes about with a coarse cloth on top yet carries jade in his bosom.” We find similar themes in stories of other Buddhist figures (for example, Dao’an, 312-385) as well as the Prophet Muhammad. The tradition of Huineng’s being orphaned and cared for by his mother echoes the biography of Mencius (ca. 385-312 BCE), one of the most revered and mystical of Confucian sages.

Huineng’s potential is recognized by the truly wise (for example, Hongren) but he must first be tested to prove his worth. His assignment to hard labor for nine months in seclusion suggests a type of spiritual gestation. Moreover, Huineng’s attaining official recognition under cover of darkness, symbolized in the passing on of Bodhidharma’s robe and bowl (sacred relics imbued with the Patriarch’s charisma), underscores the drama of this moment and the immense value of his precious wisdom. The tradition that these were buried with him indicates something else of importance: Huineng’s successors would no longer rely on India; Chan would henceforth be a homegrown Chinese tradition. Huineng’s turning down the imperial summons recalls the similar story involving Zhuangzi wherein the Daoist sage prefers to live as a turtle, “dragging his tail in the mud” (Zhuangzi, chapter 17). Finally, the accounts of Huineng’s death clearly echo the earthly passing (parinirvana) of Sakyamuni Buddha. Symbolically, Chan tradition, by drawing such a wide assortment of sacred figures into Huineng’s own story, has effectively absorbed these holy personages’ collective mana. As such, Chan is then empowered to project this “new” sacred aura down through its own lineage.

We can also understand the traditional story of Huineng’s life as an example of the apparently universal “Hero Myth.” He starts off as an unpromising youth living in obscurity who embarks on a great quest. Along the way he is aided by various helpers (the anonymous man who recited the Diamond Sutra, the nun devoted to the Nirvana Sutra, his first meditation teacher). After various adventures he meets a true mentor, the Wise Old Man (Hongren), who recognizes his worth and proceeds to train and test him until he is ready. Then the Wise Old Man passes on the secret knowledge he will need to face all obstacles. The climactic story of Huineng’s flight, pursuit, confrontation on mountain top, and his victory all fit in broad outline the structure of such tales the world over. His encounter with the dragon, of course, is the stereotypical battle with the monster (cf. St. George and the Dragon, Beowulf and Grendel) through which the Hero saves society from the threat of evil and chaos, while his refusal of imperial status demonstrates his humility and desire to avoid self-glorification. In this light, the master’s death marks his apotheosis and rise to divine status, for which he is revered by later generations.

When assessing the life of Huineng and his place in Chan lore, it is vital to bear in mind the centrality of lineage in Chinese culture. Lineage is a primary marker of group identity and solidarity, as well as social recognition. Chan, like other Chinese religious/philosophical traditions, is organized as a system of lineages in which teachings are passed down from Master (Patriarch) to disciple, much as family heritage passes down from father to son. The concern for lineage is most evident in sections 49-51 of the Platform Sutra, where Huineng traces the transmission of his teachings back through various masters to Bodhidharma. In Huineng’s Chan genealogy, Bodhidharma, in turn, received the teachings via a series of Indian masters going back to Sakyamuni. Such an impressive pedigree no doubt brought much prestige to those within the Chan line. The importance of lineage continued through the succeeding generations and was carried over when Chan went to Japan. To this day, Chan teachers trace their lineage back to Huineng. Essentially, Huineng has become the Primary Ancestor of the Chan line, receiving the reverence and devotion typical of ancestral cults throughout East Asia. Metaphorically speaking, Huineng is Chan, and remains so even today.

Such critical analysis of the Platform Sutra and the body of lore surrounding Huineng is not intended to dismiss Chan tradition (particularly in regards to the matter of lineage) as fraudulent. Rather, it helps us understand the concerns of early Chan and the vital role that a charismatic hero such as Huineng plays in rhetorically establishing a distinctive Chan identity. For an analogy we can look to the way in which the great Song scholar Zhu Xi (1130-1200) constructs a lineage for his school of Neo-Confucianism, with Confucius taking the place of Huineng and Master Zhu serving as the Confucian version of Shenhui.

4. Central Teachings

Although Huineng’s mythic biography is fascinating, the Platform Sutra mainly consists of an extended series of dharma talks offering what is at times some rather cryptic advice on Chan cultivation. Like most sermons, the Sutra is not a systematic presentation of defined doctrines and arguments but is an address to the faithful, exhorting them to see into their “original nature” and awaken here and now. Huineng explicitly says that his teachings do not originate with him but are, “handed down from the sages of the past” (section 12). Nonetheless, Huineng does introduce several important ideas and initiates the peculiar style of teaching that comes to be enshrined in later Chan tradition. These teachings tend to overlap and interlock with each other, thereby suggesting the unity-cum-diversity that is one of the hallmarks of Chan thought.

a. Major Themes

i. Original/Inherent Enlightenment (ben jue)

The teaching of “inherent” or “original” enlightenment is a major theme in Huineng’s sermon, and the theoretical basis for most of what he says regarding practice. Its roots go back to Indian teachings concerning the tathagata-garbha (“womb/embryo of Buddha”). Although a complex notion, essentially this teaching comes down to a positive articulation of basic Buddhist views on emptiness (shunyata) and the thoroughly interrelated nature of existence. According to tathagata-garbha teachings, although all beings are mired in ignorance and suffering, our true natures are always pure and luminous – defilements are merely adventitious. Awakening occurs when we pierce through the defilements and allow our original purity to shine forth. While at first glance, the assertion of a seemingly permanent “nature” would seem to contradict the fundamental Buddhist doctrine of anatman (“no [permanent] self”), in fact it does not. The tathagata-garbha is not a substantive essence but an indication of the innate positive tendency towards awakening that is always directly at hand.

Tathagata-garbha teachings had strong appeal for the Chinese, most likely due to their resonance with Confucian ideas of “propriety” (yi, the appropriate manner of acting in a given situation) and humanity’s innate “goodness,” as well as Daoist views of the Way (dao), in which each thing uniquely contributes to the all-encompassing system of the cosmos. These notions also dovetail with the traditional Chinese concern with one’s “nature” (xing, the inborn organic pattern guiding a thing’s development). Together such ideas sketch out a distinctive worldview of dynamic, interactive relationships that unfold in the natural course of things. In this perspective, one can obstruct one’s inherent tendencies or open conscientiously into a more free and responsive way of engagement. In general, the latter is the truer, more proper (or “natural”) way of being. Chinese Buddhists speak of this potential for realization as one’s “Buddha-nature” (fo xing). For Chinese Buddhists, awakening is the natural result of activating or “seeing into” this innate but hidden potential and manifesting it here and now.

Nearly everything Huineng says is predicated on the “Buddha-nature.” We see this clearly in his youthful exchanges with both the nameless Buddhist nun and Master Hongren. Huineng drives this point home in a number of places, often quite explicitly. As he proclaims, “Since Buddha is made by your own nature, do not look for him outside your body. If you are deluded in your own nature, Buddha is then a sentient being; if you are awakened in your own natures, sentient beings are then Buddhas.” (section 35) In this understanding of Buddhahood, one may have an initial awakening (Japanese satori) but this is only a hurried glimpse, yet it provides a vague understanding that spurs one on further – something we clearly see in Huineng’s own life with his first awakening at hearing a passage from the Diamond Sutra.

By rhetorically taking his stand on this inherent enlightenment, Huineng challenges his audience to understand this truth and realize their original natures where they are at this very moment. This is something they can and must do: “Despite heterodox views, passions, ignorance, and delusions, in your own physical bodies you have in yourselves the attributes of inherent enlightenment, so that with correct views you can be saved.” (section 21) It is on this basis that he speaks of such things as the unity of meditation (dhyana) and wisdom (prajna), and the “samadhi of oneness. By realizing one’s “Buddha-nature” one naturally moves beyond habitual “selfish” actions and joining with things in an appropriate and compassionate way.

ii. Non-duality

Another important theme that Huineng preaches concerns the fundamentally “non-dual” nature of existence. This, too, is prone to be misunderstood. Huineng never espouses a mushy notion that “All is One” so much as challenge the assumption that a person stands apart from her/his immediate situation. His target is the self-conscious sense of separation that tends to arise out of deliberative thinking and living. Thus, his focus is not so much theoretical as practical; one must not get caught up in speculative thought but realize (make real) Buddha, one’s true nature, and act accordingly. This fundamental unity comes through in his famous dharma verse through which he won Hongren’s robe. By countering Shenxiu’s verse and its assumptions of duality, Huineng graphically tells us that we must not think of our minds as something distinct that “we” must polish to reflect truth. Rather, we are truth, immediately and directly.

The vision Huineng seeks to impart is one of integrity within our larger context. It is an evocation of wholeness, interrelatedness and participation rather than separation and distinction. One of Huineng’s most provocative presentations of this idea comes in his discussion of meditation. For Huineng, meditation is not a separate “thing” from wisdom, nor do you attain the latter by way of the former. As he says, “Never under any circumstances say mistakenly that meditation and wisdom are different; they are a unity, not two things. Meditation itself is the substance of wisdom; wisdom itself is the function of meditation” (section 13). Later, the Patriarch explains their relationship through the analogy of a lamp and its light: just as the lamp and its illuminating are essentially one, so meditation and wisdom are one.

Huineng also challenges assumptions of separation by advocating the “samadhi of oneness,” or concentrated attention to the present situation: “The samadhi of oneness is straightforward mind at all times, walking, staying, sitting, and lying.” This constitutes an intriguing practice of mindful, meditative action performed with attentive detachment. There are obvious echoes between this practice and the Daoist notion of wei wuwei (“acting without acting”) as well as path of karma yoga outlined by Krishna in the Bhagavad-Gita, and Chan communities to this day seek to instill such an approach to life throughout their daily regimen.

This fundamental unity of existence that one manifests by realizing one’s “Buddha-nature” also informs Huineng’s view of the Pure Land (the “Western Paradise”) which, following the Vimalakirti Sutra (where the Buddha shows his disciples that this world is the Pure Land for those with Pure Mind), he refuses to allow us to conceive the Pure Land as something separate from our current existence. It is, rather, the straightforward mind of the “samadhi of oneness.” In attaining this state of true purity, one finds no obstructions. Or, as Huineng puts it, “If inside and outside are clear, this will be no different from the Western Land” (section 35).

iii. No-thought (wu nian)

Huineng speaks from the standpoint of Ultimate Truth (the inherent “Buddha-nature”) the non-dual reality lying beyond our everyday unenlightened experience of separation and division. To awaken to this Truth, Huineng emphasizes “non-clinging” to any verbal teachings, which only present obstacles to True Awakening. Instead, Huineng stresses the perspective of “no-thought” (wu nian), an open, non-conceptual state of mind that allows one to experience reality directly, as it truly is. As he states, “No thought is not to think even when involved in thought. . . To be unstained in all environments is called no-thought. If on the basis of your own thoughts you separate from environment, then, in regard to things, thoughts are not produced. If you stop thinking of the myriad things, and cast aside all thoughts, as soon as one instant of thought is cut off, you will be reborn in another realm.” (section 13)

Note that Huineng explicitly says “no-thought” is not a state of insentiency, nor is it a way of valorizing irrational, “thoughtless” behavior. Rather, “no-thought” is a highly attentive yet unentangled way of being — seemingly the only genuine freedom available. Those who act from the perspective of “no-thought” respond compassionately in all situations, untouched by suffering, much the same way the Mahayana scriptures speak of bodhisattvas (enlightened beings who selflessly seek to aid others) who “course in the Perfection of Wisdom.”

iv. Sudden Awakening (dun wu)

Few ideas are so closely associated with Huineng’s Chan than “sudden awakening” (dun wu). Rooted in earlier Buddhist and Daoist teachings, it primarily referred to statements of truth a sage made in relationship to specific audiences. Those that were direct and profound were given to those ready for such a “sudden” dose of reality whereas those that were more indirect and metaphorical were provided for those who needed to be led “gradually.” The difference, thus, lies in those who receive the teachings rather than the actual content of the teachings. Some are, as it were, closer to their “Buddha-nature.” According to later Chan tradition, Huineng advocated the (superior) way of “sudden awakening” in contrast to Shenxiu, whose dharma verse clearly points to the (inferior) way of “gradual awakening.”

This polemical distinction, however, does not capture Huineng’s full meaning. The term dun, typically translated as “sudden,” might better be rendered as “poised” or “ready” for some great undertaking Those who experience such “sudden awakening” are those who are “keen” and “fast,” ready to awaken in action, poised to break through to fuller, wise and compassionate living. By contrast, those who are “dull” are “slow,” not quite as prepared or attentive to respond in so wise a fashion. Equally as important, moreover, is Huineng’s insistence that from the standpoint of the “Buddha-nature,” there is no “sudden” or “gradual.” Thus he notes, “The dharma itself is the same, but in seeing it there is a slow way and a fast way. Seen slowly, it is the gradual; seen fast it is the sudden [teaching]. Dharma is without sudden or gradual, but some people are keen and others dull; hence the names ‘sudden’ and ‘gradual.’” (section 39)

v. The Centrality of Practice

In many respects the necessity of practice may be the single most important refrain in Huineng’s sermons. Huineng repeatedly emphasizes that Chan life, awakening, is not attained through study or careful deliberation but live action. One of the best instances comes immediately after he explains what seated meditation (zuochan; Japanese zazen) is: “Good friends, see for yourselves the purity of your own natures, practice and accomplish for yourselves. Your own nature is the Dharmakaya [“Body of the Teaching,” the Ultimate Truth] and self-practice is the practice of Buddha; by self-accomplishment you may achieve the Buddha Way for yourselves.” (section 19)

To achieve Buddhahood one must be Buddha, that which, paradoxically, one always already is. Such awakened living cannot be adequately explained through words so much as demonstrated and acted upon. In this sense, one learns it directly by conforming to an already established pattern, internalizing it, and then acting this out in any given situation. An analogy might be learning to play a musical instrument or another activity such as riding a bicycle. Chan practice is Chan doing, something that can only be learned through careful imitation of a living example – one’s Master. It is this type of first-hand learning to which Bodhidharma refers in his famous verse: “A special transmission outside the scriptures; not dependent on words and letters.”

Ironically, despite his constant injunctions to wise action, Huineng provides little detail on the specifics of practice. As a result, scholars are unsure what sorts of actual practices were taught in early Chan communities. This silence on specifics, however, turned out to be a point in Huineng’s favor, as his injunctions could readily be applied to a wide variety of Chan styles through the ages.

b. Teaching Style

Huineng’s presentation in the Platform Sutra pioneered Chan’s distinct teaching style that makes use of paradox and cryptic statements aimed at jolting students out of their habitual discursive reasoning. By no means, of course, is Huineng the inventor of such discourse (it is very common in Buddhist and Daoist texts) but in the Platform Sutra Huineng uses it with uncanny skill. As such, it warrants close examination.

One of the most significant features of Huineng’s discourse is its overwhelmingly dialogical character. Although it has its share of lectures, this “sermon” is more often a series of exchanges between Huineng and various interlocutors. Such a literary form calls for one to shift perspective back and forth. Like normal conversation, so a dialogue also tends to lead one beyond the immediate horizon, inviting listeners (and readers) to come along. Dialogue is a common form in Western philosophy (most notably in Plato’s dialogues) yet there is also ample precedent in both Buddhist and Chinese literature. The Perfection of Wisdom Sutras, the primary scriptures of Mahayana Buddhism, are all extended dialogues between the Buddha and his disciples, while most of the Analects and the Zhuangzi are dialogues as well. The dialogue is a powerful rhetorical form, dramatic and challenging, one that demands a response from its audience.

One of the more common rhetorical forms in Buddhism is paradox, and Huineng certainly makes use of this in his teaching. Thus, for instance, he admonishes his students, “Do not depart from deceptions and errors; for they of themselves are the nature of True Reality” (section 27). Later when on the point of death, he takes his closest disciples to task for their ignorance by saying, “All of you sit down. I shall give you a verse, the verse of the true-false moving-quiet.” (section 48) There is something very tricky in such sayings, as they are seemingly contradictory if not absurd. The point of a paradox, of course, is that such absurdity is only apparent for the paradox masks a higher truth that we must divine ourselves. As such, paradox is a highly suggestive form of rhetoric, one that presents us with a basic tension, leaving it for us to resolve.

Huineng also engages in a great deal of polemics in the Platform Sutra. For example, he continually contrasts the “wise” with the “deluded.” He also draws a sharp contrast between his teachings and those of the “Northern school” (secs. 37, 39, 48-49), criticizes a student whose “practice” consists of only reciting the Lotus Sutra (sec. 42), and even converts a “spy” who seems to have come to discredit him (secs. 40-41). While a polemical style may have negative connotations it also serves several rhetorical purposes. To begin, it sets the Master and his audience apart from others, thereby emphasizing that this teaching is different or special. It also underscores the challenging nature of the teaching, and no doubt directly counters various preconceived ideas in the audience. Indeed, it may even put his disciples and audience on the defensive, thus setting them up psychologically for a deeper breakthrough.

All in all, Huineng’s teaching style is quite challenging. At times it is highly provocative, even maddening. He does not lay his subjects out neatly so that his audience can absorb what he says with ease but jars his listeners to elicit a reaction from them. His words, thus, are inherently unstable and elusive, pouring forth quixotically. They resist final definition and closure, similar to Zhuangzi’s “goblet words” (zhi yan, cf. Zhuangzi chapter 27) or what the fifth century Buddhist thinker Sengzhao terms “wild words” (kuan yan, cf. his essay “Panruo Wuzhi”). Such stylistic considerations, in the end, suggest that the ultimate message of Huineng’s sermon may not be so much what he says as how he says it and how we take up his words in our response.

5. Influences

As noted above, Huineng himself claims that nothing in his teachings originates with him, much as Confucius does in Analects 15.28. Clearly, what he iterates in the Platform Sutra derives from earlier works and there are many times when he makes explicit references to other texts, notably the Diamond, Vimalakirti, and Lotus Sutras. In addition, we should also mention the Nirvana Sutra, a text promoting the universality of the “Buddha-nature” that had a profound influence on Chinese Buddhism as a whole. The influences, however, go far beyond this short list. Huineng demonstrates knowledge of the great body of Prajna-paramita (Perfection of Wisdom) literature (of which the Diamond Sutra is one rather late example), as well as the techniques of the Madhyamika school – notably in the negation of set positions, dialectic play between “conventional” and “Ultimate” truth, and the constant challenge to any attempts at a final articulation of Buddhist truth. In addition, at certain points he reveals a basic familiarity with Pure Land doctrine (sec. 35) and some rather technical aspects of Abhidharma and Yogacara philosophy (sec. 45)

Moreover, Huineng’s teachings and style of presentation also owe a great deal to indigenous Chinese sources. This is most obvious when it comes to Daoism, as Huineng’s character and actions so often epitomize teachings found in both the Daode jing and the Zhuangzi. As for Confucian tradition, Huineng makes an obvious bow to Confucius in presenting himself as a transmitter, while his adherence to the positive power of “Buddha nature” owes at least something to the Mencian idea of “inherent goodness” of human nature, a perennial theme in Chinese philosophy that finds one of its most popular articulations in the Zhongyong (“Doctrine of the Mean”). Other scholars have even suggested that portions of the Platform Sutra may have been compiled under the influence of the Yijing.

The fact that Huineng quotes passages from such a large body of works and that scholars can so-easily discern other literary influences and allusions constitutes further proof that the tradition of Huineng’s illiteracy should not be taken literally. In the Platform Sutra Huineng proves rather erudite, if not bookish. His familiarity with so much of his Buddhist and Chinese heritage challenges stereotypes of Chan as denigrating and even ignoring written texts. Indeed, scholars of Buddhism often point out the ironic fact that Chan, so often known for its dismissal of texts, has the largest body of written work of any East Asian Buddhist tradition. Furthermore, many great Chan masters (for example, Dogen, 1200-1253) were brilliant scholars and original thinkers. This paradoxical aspect of Chan, rather than being the product of centuries of institutionalization as some might claim, seems to have been there from the very beginning.

6. Critical Issues

Although the Platform Sutra is most unusual for a “philosophical” text, both in terms of style and content it raises a number of issues that are of particular philosophic import.

a. The Role of Reason and Rationality

Chan has a reputation for irrationality, allegedly insisting that practitioners cut off thinking entirely. There is some basis for such views, and in Chan history we do find examples where this seems to have been encouraged, as, for example, in the case of the Baotang school of Chan that developed in Sichuan during eighth century. Huineng and most Chan masters, however, do not advocate a disorderly or irrational lifestyle. Their concern, instead, seems to be on the predominance of ratio (deliberative, analytic thinking) and the discursive reasoning that severs aspects of reality into discrete bits, usually from an egocentric standpoint. From a Chan perspective, this mode of understanding is the result of a highly artificial process that cuts one off from full participation in one’s immediate context and inevitably leads to suffering. Such an approach cannot be countered with rational, objective arguments because such reasoning is itself a product of such a mode of understanding. By breaking the grip of such processes on humanity, Huineng and his later followers seek to free us for a fuller, more natural life, and hence a truer life.

Much of the difficulty surrounding this subject stems from Chan’s distinctive rhetorical style, of which Huineng is a true master. In particular the notion of “no-thought” seems to suggest a sort of mindless, purely instinctual response or perhaps even unconsciousness. Certainly, “no-thought” is not rational in the sense of bare objectivity. In fact, as we have seen, “no-thought” is not this at all but more like an attitude of carefully attentiveness to the situation at hand. If “no-thought” is lacking in anything it would be the self-consciousness that typically arises out of the dualism inherent in subject-object thinking. Most assuredly “no-thought” should not be equated with becoming insentient, that is, an “object” among others.

Is there a place for reason in all this? Not in the ordinary sense. However, Chan would seem to be less “irrational” than “a rational,” although such labels themselves are designations arising within discursive reasoning. In the end, it may be helpful to view Huineng as espousing a type of “philosophy as propaganda,” much like Nagarjuna or the later Wittgenstein. The aim is not to argue but to change one’s way of thinking in favor of a more immediate and direct way of being.

b. Sudden vs. Gradual?

Much has been made of this notion in Chan scholarship and, indeed, Chan tradition often presents the as a conflict of “Northern Chan Gradualism” and “Southern Chan Subitism” – an alleged conflict from which the latter emerged victorious. In reality it is not really so simple, but the contrast points to an instable dynamic that lies at the heart of Buddhism and perhaps all spiritual practice. If “sudden awakening” refers to an instantaneous experience of enlightenment at which point nothing more needs to be done, then why did someone like Huineng continue to sit in meditation through his later years and exhort his students to do the same even after his death (section 53)?

In fact, what Huineng says about the contrast between “sudden” and “gradual” is anything but clear: “Good friends, in the dharma there is no sudden or gradual, but among people some are keen and others dull. The deluded recommend the gradual method, the enlightened practice the sudden teaching. . . Once enlightened, there is from the outset no distinction between these two methods; those who are not enlightened with for long kalpas be caught in the cycle of transmigration” (section 16). In part it appears that the distinction between “sudden” and “gradual” is a provisional one made from the unawakened standpoint that applies to Chan practitioners rather than the actual event of awakening itself. Yet can one move from delusion to enlightenment, from gradual to sudden? It also seems that the difference between “sudden” and “gradual” cannot refer to a temporal distinction, for even a “sudden awakening” certainly cannot be attained easily or without much practice; Huineng had several “sudden awakenings” but devoted himself to a lifetime of Chan practice.

Later Chan thinkers such as Zongmi (a.k.a. Guifeng, 780-841) were deeply concerned about these notions and sought to clarify them by speaking of “sudden awakening followed by gradual cultivation.” While intriguing, such a solution essentially erases any ultimate meaning to the sudden/gradual distinction. It also implies that claims to “sudden awakening” by Huineng and his followers line were rhetorical rather than genuine.

c. The Role of Text (wen) in Life

The reputation of Chan as eschewing textual study has long been a source of controversy and great appeal. We can see this even in the “Chan motto” attributed to Bodhidharma in which the dharma is said to be a “separate transmission outside the scriptures, not relying on words and letters.” There can be no arguing that Chan presents a basic distrust of scholasticism that seems to have characterized the Chinese doctrinal schools such as Tiantai and Huayan. But does this mean that texts have no place? This would hardly seem to be warranted given what we find in the Platform Sutra. In the autobiographical portions of the Sutra Huineng has his initial awakening from hearing a text (the Diamond Sutra), demonstrates his worth through his own “dharma verse,” and received official dharma transmission through verbal teachings from Hongren. Moreover, Huineng’s sermon is full of instances in which he unfolds the various meanings in a number of Buddhist texts. In addition, there are several passages in which Huineng draws attention to the text of his sermon itself, stating “If others are able to encounter the Platform Sutra, it will be as if they received the teaching personally from me” (section 47). The text goes on to note that Huineng’s closest disciples received his teaching, made copies of the Platform Sutra and entrusted them to later generations, all of whom were led through it to see into their own true natures.

An important clue for our understanding can be found when Huineng is preparing to give his “death verse.” Before launching into his final teaching he tells his disciples, “if you understand its meaning, you will be the same as I” (section 48). Like Sakyamuni before his passing, Huineng promises that that the master will remain with his students in the form of his teachings. These teachings, compiled in textual form, will have the power to lead hearers and readers to realization of their True natures once they grasp the teachings’ true import. In this reading, the Master’s role is open up the teachings via his own words (or actions) and so manifest their meaning; the crucial point is that these are transmitted by the Master and taken up by the students – a process that can only happen “outside the scriptures” themselves. There is an interesting parallel here to the view of the Neo-Confucian master Zhu Xi, who, in outlining the regimen of study for his disciples, emphasizes the importance of texts as a coming into the very presence of the Sages themselves.

The conclusion seems to be that Huineng does not denigrate texts per se, for they were instrumental in his own awakening and play a central role in his sermons. Instead, he (and later Chan tradition) attacks the tendency to treat them objectively, as material to be mastered rather than dharma gates leading to awakening. Ego, cutting off from full involvement in the world. Taking texts truly as “scripture,” however, is another matter. The words of dharma are Buddha in that they allow us to perceive truth. In this view, then, those passages in the Platform Sutra calling attention to the text itself emphasize its way of connecting one with Huineng’s wisdom offered for our awakening. What we see then is that through Huineng, Chan celebrates the centrality of text, but as “live word” internalized and acted upon rather than mere marks on the page. Such an existential engagement, however, is not typically found in the modern study of philosophy and so raises questions about what “philosophy” may actually be.

d. The Relation of Action (praxis) and Knowledge (theoria)

The centrality of practice is a major refrain in Huineng’s discourse. Despite his often-cryptic comments, the Master shares the decidedly practical focus that runs through much of Chinese philosophic culture. Time and time again, Huineng exhorts us to a life of Chan action and practice, a life of Buddhahood, rather than quietistic withdrawal. Although clearly there is some sort of “theory” informing Huineng (a sinified version of tathagatha-garbha teachings), this never takes precedence over practical application. In fact, Huineng (and Chan in general) refuses to distinguish between these two concepts, arguing essentially that true knowing is practical action. Thus, from this perspective nothing can be “true in theory” if it is not borne out in practice.

The priority of praxis is underscored by the fact that Chan is often regarded first and foremost as a “practice school.” In contrast to the doctrinal concerns of the Tiantai and Huayan, Chan emphasizes practices such as “no-thought” while maintaining that getting tangled up in mistaken ideas inevitably leads one astray. Since we are already Buddha, we must realize this through Buddha living. Only then are we awakened to the truth of our original (Buddha) nature.

There are some interesting analogies to Huineng’s perspective that provide much food for thought. Socrates, for example, famously argues that “to know the good is to do the good,” implying that true understanding is always attested in actual life. In a different vein, there is also Martin Heidegger’s existential analysis of dasein in which he focuses on our unreflective “being-in-the-world” as demonstrating a prior unthematized Understanding, that is, our actual (as opposed to theoretical) knowledge of things. Perhaps the most obvious analogy, however, can be found in the work of Wang Yangming (Wang Shouren, 1472-1529). Among his teachings, Wang maintained that knowing and acting formed an essential original unity that people often separate through their own selfish desires. In fact, Wang explained to one of his greatest disciples, “There have never been people who know but do not act. Those who are supposed to know but do not act simply do not know.”

e. The Centrality of Ritual (Li)

This matter has received little attention until recently but is an outgrowth of the general Chinese focus on practice. We have already seen that in the Platform Sutra Huineng constantly preaches to his charges to act upon his teachings, putting them into practice. This preaching, of course, is itself a type of Chan practice and, in fact, occurs within a ritual context and in a temple setting. Giving and listening to a “dharma talk” are both highly ritualized activities that follow their own specified rules. Furthermore, Huineng repeatedly enjoins his followers to chant certain vows aloud and to take various types of precepts. Thus the entire discourse is pervaded by a strong sense of ritual, or li. There is a strong, albeit implicit message here that Huineng is calling for participation in specific activities from all those in his audience, that is, all who hear or read the Platform Sutra.

Adherence to li, of course, has been a primary focus of Chinese culture from the very earliest times, and philosophical discussion of li plays a central role in Chinese thought since at least the time of Confucius. Moreover, li by their very nature are a form of highly regulated activity that require repeated engagement to learn. One learns the li by doing the li. Huineng and the text of the Platform Sutra thus underscore the highly ritualized nature of Chan life, a fact that several scholars have noted and which provides yet another strong contrast to popular (mis)understandings of Chan. Rather than being an incitement to egocentric spontaneity (which would result in utter chaos, and hence more delusion and suffering), the “sudden awakening” espoused by Huineng can only occur within a ritual context in which all parties are actively engaged. Those involved are not “doing their own thing” but participating in a shared activity in which all energies are marshaled in concert. It is just for this reason that Huineng stresses the “samadhi of oneness” and Chan monastic training involves meditation training not just during periods of actual physical sitting but throughout all daily activities.

7. Impact on Later Buddhist and Chinese Philosophical Traditions

Huineng’s impact on Chan is without parallel. Not only did he articulate the major themes that came to dominate Chan discourse and practice, he provided the model of the ideal Master. By the late eighth century, two main branches of Chan existed: the “Northern” and “Southern” schools. Claiming to have studied under Huineng, Shenhui (684-758) launched an attack on the legitimacy of “Northern” Chan, which enjoyed imperial patronage during the Tang dynasty (618-907) under the leadership of Master Shenxiu (ca. 606-706) and his heir, Puji (651-739). Alleging that his teacher was the true recipient of dharma transmission and ridiculing the latter’s “gradualist” approach to awakening, Shenhui insisted that Huineng was the real Sixth Patriarch and claimed the title of Seventh Patriarch for himself. Shenhui’s claims carried the day and by the ninth century, the “Southern” school with its teaching of “sudden awakening” was accepted as the official line. Ironically, both the “Northern” and “Southern” schools eventually died out as direct lineages. It was only later that, having survived the imperial persecutions of 841-845, other Chan schools reasserted their connection(s) to Huineng and so enshrined the tale of unilinear dharma transmission.

The Platform Sutra became wildly popular in China, perhaps because of its paradoxical “Daoist” air, and numerous copies circulated. The traditional version, printed some five hundred years after the oldest version, is almost twice the size of the original due to later additions and expansions. Huineng’s idiosyncratic way of discussing the sutras, less of a strict exegesis and more a performance of their message, a practice known as tichang (Japanese teisho) set the standard for a Chan “dharma talk.” Stories of Huineng are scattered throughout the various gong’an (Japanese koan) collections. Perhaps the most famous of these allegedly comes from Huineng’s confrontation with Huiming, the fierce former general who came to kill him on the mountaintop. As the Huiming approached, the Master asked, “Not thinking of good, not thinking of evil, just at this moment, what is our original face before your mother and father were born?” Huiming at once became enlightened. This koan is still one of the first given to beginning students in Japanese Zen monasteries.

By inaugurating a powerful new approach to the dharma, however, Huineng had impact far beyond Buddhism and Chan. Philosophically, the strongest effect was on Neo-Confucianism, a major response of Confucian tradition to the challenges offered by Buddhism, particularly Chan. Each of the “Five Great Masters” (Zhou Dunyi, Zhang Zai, Cheng Yi, Cheng Hao, Zhu Xi) studied Chan at some point in their youth, and the records of their discussions with students as well as the anecdotes concerning their lives (collected in such works as Reflections on Things at Hand) strongly resemble later Chan collections such as the Wumen guan (The Gateless Gate). Chan influence on Wang Yangming is so great as to scarcely need comment.

As for Daoism, the most obvious impact Chan had was on the formation of the Quanzhen (“Complete Perfection”) school, a monastic sect that originated in the twelfth century. The Quanzhen sect shows blatant Chan influence, from its code of regulations, meditation techniques, and even the layout of its monastic compounds. The school’s founder, Wang Chongyang (1112-1170), with his cryptic teaching style and insistence on diligent practice at all times, could even be one of Huineng’s disciples.

The portrait of Huineng emerging from Chan tradition and the Platform Sutra in particular is quite compelling. The Master is portrayed as brilliant despite (or because of) his humble beginnings and takes on a truly heroic stature through his trials and eventual triumph. In his statements, Huineng comes across as immensely charismatic. He is by turns insightful, iconoclastic and humorous. Throughout his discourse he challenges his audience to leave behind intellectual preconceptions while undercutting all attempts to grasp his meaning by rational means. Ironically, during this lengthy verbal discourse he proclaims, “the practice of self-awakening does not lie in verbal arguments.” (section 38) This despite offering long harangues against Chan practitioners who have “false views.” Huineng, thus, is the archetypal Chan Master, a model for all later Chan practitioners. We can even see traces of Huineng in the character of Yoda, the great Jedi master from the Star Wars film series. At one point in Episode V: The Empire Strikes Back, Yoda famously tells his disciple Luke Skywalker, “Do, or do not — there is no ‘try’!” — a line that could be straight from the Platform Sutra. Truly, Huineng lives on.

8. References and Further Reading

Dumoulin, Heinrich. Zen Buddhism: A History. Vol. 1, India and China. New York: Macmillan, 1988.
- The first in a nearly exhaustive two-volume treatment of the history of Chan/Zen Buddhism (the second volume deals exclusively with Japan). Accessible, detailed, interesting, this is a fine scholarly overview that both beginners and experts will find useful.
Faure, Bernard. The Rhetoric of Immediacy: A Cultural Critique of Chan/Zen Buddhism. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1995.
Faure, Bernard. The Will to Orthodoxy: A Critical Genealogy of Northern Chan Buddhism. Stanford: Stanford University Press, 1997.
- Along with Faure’s Ch’an Insights and Oversights (1993), these two works exemplify the detailed, technical studies of Chan/Zen that have emerged during the past two decades. Faure draws heavily on Postmodern figures (Foucault, Derrida) in his powerful, wide-ranging yet insightful critical “unmasking” of traditional understandings of Chan and Zen.
Hershock, Peter D. Chan Buddhism. Honolulu: University of Hawaii Press, 2005.
- Part of the “Dimensions of Asian Spirituality” series, this may be the finest one volume overview of Chan/Zen available in English. Hershock skillfully steers a “middle way” between critical-historical scholarship and insight into the spiritual meaning of Chan/Zen teachings and practice. An admitted practicing Buddhist for over 20 years, Hershock fleshes out his “Zen Bones” with profiles of Huineng as well as other Chan masters (Bodhidharma, Mazu, and Linji). In the end he presents Chan/Zen as a vital practice that has the potential to help us shed our ego boundaries and open ourselves to our fellow human beings.
Hershock, Peter D. Liberating Intimacy: Enlightenment and Social Virtuosity in Ch’an Buddhism. Albany: State University of New York Press, 1996.
- Hershock’s first book on Chan, presenting a unique and insightful philosophical take stressing Chan as a tradition of practice in the world. As the title suggests, Hershock maintains that Chan is a way towards achieving “liberating intimacy” with other sentient beings. A masterful refutation of charges that Chan/Zen is mere self-indulgent “navel gazing” or that it encourages antinomian or immoral behavior.
Jorgenson, John. Inventing Hui-neng, the Sixth Patriarch: Hagiography and Biography in Early Ch’an. Leiden: E. J. Brill Academic Publishing, 2005.
- A recent critical analysis of the Huineng legend and the saga of Early Chan. The author uses the life of Confucius as the model on which Huineng’s biography is based. Very good at showing the influence of Confucianism, politics etc. on early Chan. The cover photo of Huineng’s alleged “mummy” alone is startling.
McRae, John R. The Northern School and the Formation of Early Ch’an Buddhism. Honolulu: University of Hawaii Press, 1986.
- A major scholarly work drawing heavily on critical Japanese scholarship. McRae was one of the first to truly take on the traditional Chan/Zen story of the “Northern” versus “Southern” school.
Price, A.F., and Wong Mou-lam, trans. The Diamond Sutra and the Sutra of Hui-Neng. Boston: Shambhala Publications, Inc., 1990.
- One of the special “Shambhala Dragon Editions” series, this work presents two of the most important texts in early Chan, and does so from a Chan perspective. While not scholarly by any means (there are very few notes), they definitely capture the iconoclastic spirit of Chan. As if to underscore this, a famous 13th century black ink painting of Huineng tearing up a sutra graces its cover. Wong’s translation of the Platform Sutra was the first ever done into English (in the 1930’s), and for that reason alone it is significant. It includes some episodes not in the Dunhuang version translated by Yampolsky (see below).
Suzuki, Daisetz Teitaro. The Zen Doctrine of No-mind: the Significance of the Sutra of Hui-Neng (Wei-Lang). York Beach, ME: Weiser Books, 1972.
- Originally published in 1969, this is a posthumous work by one of the foremost (and controversial) popularizers of Zen in the West. While perhaps marked by a sort of “weisho quality,” this book demonstrates Suzuki’s awareness of critical scholarship on Chan/Zen tradition and a real understanding of many of the issues involved in Huineng’s “biography” and Zen teachings. Although not a roshi himself, Suzuki was never as much of an “outsider” to the Zen establishment as some of his critics have made him out to be. His personal experience with Zen training sharpened Suzuki’s insights and his comparisons with Christianity are thought provoking at the very least.
Yampolsky, Philip B., trans., The Platform Sutra of the Sixth Patriarch (New York: Columbia University Press, 1967.
- Still the definitive English translation, based upon the Dunhuang manuscript. All quotations in the above are taken from Yampolsky’s translation. Heavily annotated, it includes a lengthy introduction (over 100 pages), glossary, and a critical edition of the Chinese text at the very end. A must read for anyone seeking to understand Chan tradition and its most famous Patriarch.

Author Information

John M. Thompson
Email: john.thompson@cnu.edu
Christopher Newport University
U. S. A.

Fazang (Fa-tsang, 643—712 C.E.)

The Buddhist ideologue Fazang (Fa-tsang) stands as one of the foremost figures of medieval Chinese Buddhism. He lived at the very pinnacle of Chinese Buddhism among towering figures such as the legendary pilgrim and Yogacara (Faxiang) master Xuanzang (602-664), the Chan patriarch Shenxiu (d. 706) and the great chronicler Daoxuan (596-667). According to Song dynasty biographer Zanning, he was “mysterious and upright, by nature surpassingly clever and sagacious.” For the better part of his life, he worked in close proximity with the highest echelons of imperial power, deeply engaged in matters of court and country. For four decades, under a series of emperors, he served as a lecturer, a translator, a rhetorician, a propagandist, and a miracleworker. Tirelessly, he lectured on the Flower Garland Sutra, translated Buddhist sutras from Sanskrit and Khotanese (a Middle Iranian language once spoken in what is now China’s Xinjiang province) into Chinese, and wrote meticulously crafted commentaries interpreting Buddhist scripture in a manner that served to exalt his imperial patron’s status. Shortly after his death, the emperor Ruizong (r. 684-690, 710-712) praised him effusively: “The late monk Fazang inherited his virtuous karma from the Heavens and his open intelligence accorded with principle. With his eloquence and outstanding understanding, he had his mind interfused with penetrating enlightenment.” He would become known as the third patriarch and systematizer of the Flower Garland (Huayan or Hua-yen) school of Buddhism.

Biography
Thought
Works
References and Further Reading
1. Secondary Sources
2. Primary Sources

1. Biography

Fazang was a native of Sogdiana (in Chinese, Sute). This is an Iranian civilization that encompassed territories now incorporated into the modern states of Uzbekistan and Tajikistan in Central Asia. As a youth, he embraced Buddhism with fervent devotion; at sixteen, he burned off one of his fingers as an offering to the Buddha before the Aśokan reliquary in the famous Famen Temple in the Tang dynasty capital of Chang’an. Thereafter, he became a recluse on nearby Mount Taibai, where he encountered masters of the Flower Garland (Avatamsaka) Sutra. Returning to Chang’an to attend to his ailing parents, he encountered Zhiyan (602-668) and became his student and disciple. Fazang was constantly called upon to explicate the profound wonders contained in the Flower Garland Sutra, lecturing to clergy and rulers more than thirty times.

Like many eminent Buddhists, a mystical aura has grown around Fazang in subsequent hagiography. One must investigate with a careful and critical eye the many miracles and legends that surround his person. Some of the purported miracles were closely associated with his oratory prowess. In 689, when he delivered his lecture on the Flower Garland Sutra in Luoyang, a piece of auspicious ice was discovered in which, it is said, an image of “twinned pagodas” appeared. When Śiksānanda and he were translating the Flower Garland Sutra in Luoyang, a hundred-petaled lotus flower blossomed in front of the translation hall. After lectures in 692 and 696, light allegedly issued from Fazang’s mouth, prompting the congregated faithful to marvel. On other occasions, following his lectures, it is said that flowers fell from the heavens and five-colored clouds accumulated in the skies.

Fazang appears to have been a practitioner of esoteric Buddhism, which many East Asian rulers believed commanded magical powers. In 697, the throne requested that he use Buddhist scriptural magic to help defeat the Khitan, a proto-Mongolian ethnic group that once dominated what is now Manchuria. Fazang performed a ritual cleansing, changed clothes, set an eleven-faced image of the bodhisattva (an enlightened being who selflessly seeks to aid others) Guanyin (Kuan-yin) on a ritual platform, and worked his magic. Heavenly drums echoed, the image of Guanyin appeared on high, surveying the countless divine troops who materialized to combat the raiders, inspiring the Zhou forces and plunging the Khitan into despair. This triumph prompted the empress Wu Zhao to exclaim, “This is the blessed aegis of Buddha force!” and change the reign era name to Shengong (“Divine Merit”).

He was also renowned as a conjurer, capable of summoning weather. On multiple occasions, his prayers and rites brought timely rain to alleviate drought. In 687, at the empress’ behest, he prayed for rain, fasting for seven days, until the skies fortuitously opened and drenched the parched ground. Again, in 696, his prayers proved effective in bringing salubrious rain to afflicted Yongzhou. In 702, Fazang invited another monk to pray at Wuzhen Temple in Lantian, which had no spring. After three dawns of reciting sutras, a freshet suddenly jetted forth at Maitreya Pavilion, bringing vernal bounty to the surrounding lands. Under the emperor Zhongzong, when drought struck Chang’an, Fazang prayed and performed Buddhist rites for seven days, finally bringing a downpour. The following year his prayers for rain were successful once again. Under the emperor Ruizong, he relieved drought and snowless winter, his sincere prayers brought down a blizzard.

In spite of his impressive monastic, scholastic, and thaumaturgical credentials, Fazang was no detached ascetic who speculated on matters recondite and metaphysical. Under Wu Zhao (a.k.a. Empress Wu or Wu Zetian, 624-705, r. 690-705), the only female emperor in Chinese history, the Buddhist clergy was politicized as never before. Contending against a Confucian tradition that stridently opposed her assumption of power, Wu Zhao naturally sought validation for her sovereignty in Buddhism. She styled herself in Buddhist terms as a cakravartin (a universal wheel-turning monarch) and a living bodhisattva. A brilliant orator, lecturer, ideologue, rhetorician and translator, Fazang was one of many Buddhist ideologues who helped sanction her sovereignty. He differed from the vast majority of her other Buddhist supporters in that he was an independent-minded and profound thinker who lectured to Wu Zhao, rather than mustering rhetoric for her. The remarkable duration and depth of their mutual commitment also stands out. For better than three decades, beginning when he preached the Flower Garland Sutra on behalf of her recently deceased mother, he applied his abundant talents toward enhancing Wu Zhao’s reputation as a Buddhist ruler.

At a pivotal juncture of Wu Zhao’s political ascent, as part of a grand ceremony early in 689 that anticipated the inauguration of her Zhou dynasty by a single year, she ordered Fazang to convene a dharma assembly and, from an elevated seat, expound upon the Flower Garland Sutra to thousands of Buddhist monks and nuns congregated for the event. When Fazang delivered a lecture at Buddha’s Prophecy Temple in Luoyang in 700 (shortly after the completion of his new translation of the Flower Garland Sutra), the ground of the lecture hall and temple purportedly shook. Rather than interpreting this earthquake in Confucian fashion, as an inauspicious disharmony of the elements, Wu Zhao understood it as a wondrous event, praising Fazang:

Because he has extended the knowledge of the subtle and profound; disseminated wisdom on the mysterious and abstruse, on the first day of translation, I dreamed that sweet dew descended as an auspicious sign. On the morning of the lecture I felt the earth tremor, a miraculous sign. This, then, was the footfall of the Future Buddha, Maitreya, using the mandala as a lucky icon.

This marriage of ideology and power did not end happily. In Wu Zhao’s turn toward Daoist expiatory rites and longevity potions during her final years, Fazang felt a shift in his patron’s imperial favor. In early 705, Fazang transported the sacred finger-bone of the Buddha from Famen Temple to Luoyang, where Wu Zhao placed him in charge of the relic veneration ceremony, which she believed might ameliorate her declining health. In this official capacity, which provided him access to her person and to the Forbidden City, Fazang worked in tandem with conspirators from the court and betrayed his longstanding patron Wu Zhao, supporting the coup that removed her in 705. A political opportunist, he continued to promote Flower Garland Buddhism serving under emperors Zhongzong (r. 684, 705-710), Ruizong, and Xuanzong (r. 712-756). Curiously, his treachery, to no small extent, saved Buddhism from being identified as a rogue ideology used to validate one whom the Confucian establishment styled an illegitimate female usurper.

Fazang’s successful promotion and propagation of Flower Garland Buddhism under successive rulers played an important role in the subsequent spread, development and Sinification of the school. Over a period of three decades, Fazang played a leading role in these cooperative efforts among the corps of Indian, Khotanese, Sogdian, Korean and Chinese writing translations and commentaries on Buddhist sutras. In Fazang’s epistolary correspondence with Korean Flower Garland monk Ŭisang, another disciple of his master Zhiyan, it is apparent that he attempted to propagate a worldwide state without barriers, an infinite realm linked by the Mahayana Buddhist faith. Fazang also taught another Korean monk, Shimsang, who helped transmit Chinese Flower Garland Buddhism to Japan. Ultimately, these contacts helped propagate Flower Garland Buddhism, linking it to a wider pan-Asian network

2. Thought

a. Shunyata

At the very heart of Flower Garland Buddhism is the idea of what is known in Sanskrit as shunyata (“emptiness”): universal interconnectedness, all-inclusiveness, intercausality and interpenetration. Fazang did a great deal to elevate Flower Garland Buddhism over rival schools, acknowledging other Buddhist schools and sutras, but championing the Flower Garland Sutra as the central teaching of the Buddha. As the Buddha’s first sermon upon attaining enlightenment, the nearly incomprehensible Flower Garland Sutra was invested with a profundity and wisdom unequalled in the Buddha’s subsequent works. In this effort, Fazang gathered and classified the rather unsystematic and wide-ranging Buddhist teachings into five categories in order of ascending profundity and power. In ascending order: Hinayana, Initial Mahayana, Final Mahayana, Sudden Teaching of the One Vehicle (proto-Zen), and, at the pinnacle, the Comprehensive Teaching of the One Vehicle—in essence, the Flower Garland Sutra. The sense of universality allowed the Flower Garland School to be compatible with other sects, effectively encompassing their doctrine, while maintaining the overarching primacy of the Flower Garland teachings.

b. Bodhicitta

This doctrine of interdependence is also reflected in Fazang’s thoughts on bodhicitta (mental dedication to helping all sentient beings and attaining enlightenment). Following the logic that each element pervades all that exists and itself contains all other elements in the phenomenal world, “In practicing the virtues, when one is perfected, all are perfected,” he writes, “and when one first arouses the thought of enlightenment one also becomes perfectly enlightened” (trans. Wright). Fazang’s emphasis on the omniversal generative power of the tathagatagarbha, the “womb of Buddhahood,” while not unique, subsequently developed into an important concept in the East Asian Mahayana Buddhist tradition.

So that others might better comprehend the profound doctrine of the Flower Garland Sutra, Fazang used the metaphor of the Ten Mysteries (Ten Mysterious Gates) to explicate the interconnectedness and inter-causality in the Flower Garland universe. These Ten Mysteries illustrate how seemingly contradictory pairs—the hidden and the manifest, truth and falsehood, the infinite and the infinitesimal, the general and the specific–mutually complement each other and coexist without obstruction. Indra’s net (see below) is one of the Ten Mysteries.

Fazang’s ideas of an interconnected omniverse extended easily and effectively from the metaphysical realm to the political arena. Indeed, it allowed Wu Zhao to serve as the alpha link in a cosmic concatenation. Stanley Weinstein has commented “Seeing herself as a universal monarch, she must have been attracted by the Flower Garland school with its well-ordered universe presided over by Vairocana Buddha, whose every act was reflected in countless worlds.” This integrated and totalistic vision of the cosmos was “analogous to the highly centralized imperial state that she ruled.” This ideology allowed Wu Zhao to portray herself as an absolute sovereign, all-pervasive and omnipresent. This central idea of the boundless reach of the Buddha’s power and compassion, nicely paralleled and supported the idea of the infinite compass of the ruler’s authority and benevolence. Fazang’s creative presentation and flair for theater (see below), both enhanced the great aesthetic, intellectual and philosophical appeal of his ideas and made them more comprehensible. In Wu Zhao, he found a potential cakravartin to propagate the Buddhist faith; in Fazang’s profound thought, she, in turn, discovered powerful ideological justification for her authority.

c. Indra’s Net

When Fazang first lectured on the Flower Garland Sutra, the principles he expounded upon were so abstruse that the listeners were utterly dumbstruck. Therefore, to render the sutra comprehensible to his imperial patrons and to the masses of Buddhist faithful, he used metaphors such as Indra’s Net of Jewels and the Golden Lion. In the former, “In each of the jewels, the images of all the other jewels are reflected…the images multiply infinitely, and all these multiple images are bright and clear within a single jewel.” This concatenation, this mutual linking and inter-penetration, illustrates harmonious interconnectedness of everything. Here, causal sky net objects can not be conceived of independently: the nature of each object is defined by its place with relation to all other objects. He also devised a Hall of Mirrors to illustrate the workings of Indra’s Net and the power of the Buddha by arranging ten mirrors (corresponding with the Ten Mysterious Gates), eight in an octagon, one above and one below, with a statue of the Buddha set in the middle, the focal point of origin and return. When he lit a torch to illumine the centerpiece, an endless web of reflected light crisscrossed, creating an infinite series of images within images, each containing the entire Buddha. This demonstration made manifest the meaning of the inexhaustible interconnectedness of the universe, hence the infinite power of the Buddha.

d. The Golden Lion

Fazang’s most famous device of performative metaphor was a lion made of gold. The lion represents the cosmos, parts of the lion the various phenomena of the universe, while the gold represented emptiness. The lion had a mane, teeth, claws and eyes: parts that seemed distinct and unrelated. And yet the essential substance of the entire lion was the same–gold. Within each hair, paradoxically, there are infinite lions. The differences are all superficial. Such is the nature of the integrated, interconnected Flower Garland universe. After demonstrating this principle to Wu Zhao using the sculpture of a lion at the imperial palace gate around 700 (sources differ), Fazang wrote a one-chapter Essay on the Golden Lion.

In his Treatise on the Five Teachings, a house is used as a metaphor for the universe. The complex interplay between joists, uprights, roof, tenons and mortises—the sum total of structural relationships between all parts–is contained in a single rafter. The nature of the infinite can be seen in the infinitesimal. The role of the rafter–or any other component–helps one understand the interdependence of all sentient beings. Certainly, Fazang’s flair for the theatrical and his ability to convey the message to his patrons through such brilliant demonstrations, helped successfully propagate Flower Garland Buddhism.

3. Works

Much of Fazang’s energy was devoted to exegetical work on and demonstrations of the Flower Garland Sutra. He produced more than sixty original works, commentaries on a wide variety of Buddhist texts, and meditation manuals, and participated in many Buddhist translation projects. Collectively, Fazang’s works and translations must be looked at not only in terms of their metaphysical and ideological merit, but as political rhetoric consciously geared toward promoting the Flower Garland school and exalting the sovereignty of his imperial sponsors. Fazang’s Treatise on the Five Teachings detailed a hierarchy of Buddhist sects, placing, of course, Flower Garland at the apex and clarifying common ideological ground.

Fazang was a propagandist. His Huayanjing zhuanji, a commentary he wrote between 690 and 693, helped provide legitimacy for Wu Zhao’s claim to be a cakravartin. Making reference to her titles as “Sage Mother” and “Divine Sovereign,” Fazang remarked, “Both sage and divine, she makes the Six Supernatural Penetrations act without stopping; infinitely good and infinitely beautiful, she displays the Ten Goodnesses beyond all limits.”

For Wu Zhao, retranslating and reinterpreting the Flower Garland Sutra was an ongoing, high-priority political activity. Fazang played a pivotal role in this effort. The Flower Garland Sutra was at the heart of a deep-rooted and longstanding Khotanese tradition of Buddhist kingship, with a Chinese lineage going from ruler Shi Hu of the Eastern Jin in the 4th century to Liang Wudi to Sui Wendi and finally to Wu Zhao. She sent emissaries to Khotan to seek the Sanskrit version of the Flower Garland Sutra. In 679, the Indian monk Divākara presented newly recovered Sanskrit sutras at Gaozong’s court. In 684, with Divākara, Fazang worked on a translation of the Flower Garland Sutra at Western Taiyuan Temple. As preparatory work for the compilation of the new Flower Garland Sutra, Fazang compared these new texts to extant translations, noting disparities and incorporating omissions. Between 695 and 699, she recruited Khotanese monks such as Śiksānanda and Devaprajña to work in tandem with Fazang, completing a new, improved Flower Garland Sutra that was eighty chapters instead of sixty. This new Flower Garland Sutra superseded the version completed in the 680s and helped confirm Wu Zhao’s identification as a cakravartin and a bodhisattva.

4. References and Further Reading

a. Secondary Sources

Chan, Wing-tsit, ed. A Source Book in Chinese Philosophy. Princeton University Press, 1963.
Pages 406–424 include a brief survey of Flower Garland school thought and a full translation of the “Golden Lion Essay.”
Chen, Jinhua. Monks and Monarchs, Kinship and Kingship: Tanqian in Sui Buddhism and Politics. Italian School of East Asian Studies Essays Series, vol. 3. Kyoto: Scuola Italiana di Studi sull’Asia Orientale, 2002.
Chen, Jinhua. “More Than a Philosopher: Fazang (643-712) as a Politician and Miracle-worker.” History of Religions 42.4 (May 2003): 320-358.
Cook, Francis. Hua-yen Buddhism: The Jewel Net of Indra. Penn State University Press, 1977.
DeBary, Wm. Th., et al, eds. Sources of Chinese Tradition, Vol I., 2nd ed. Columbia University Press, 1999.
Pp. 471-476 includes sections from the Flower Garland Sutra such as “The Tower of Vairocana” and “Indra’s Net.”
Fang, Litian. Huayan jin shizi zhang jiaoshi, Zhongguo Fojiao dianji xuankan. Zhonghua, 1996.
Forte, Antonino. A Jewel in Indra’s Net: The Letter Sent by Fazang in China to Ŭisang in Korea. Italian School of East Asian Studies Occasional Papers 8. Kyoto, 2000.
Forte, Antonino. Mingtang and Buddhist Utopias in the History of the Astronomical Clock: The Tower, the Statue and the Armillary Sphere Constructed by Empress Wu. Rome, 1988. See pp. 121-122.
Forte, Antonino. Political Propaganda and Ideology in China at the End of the Seventh Century. Naples, 1977.
Fox, Alan. “Fazang.” Great Thinkers of the Eastern World, ed. Ian P. McGreal (HarperCollins, 1995), 99-103.
Gu, Zhengmei. “Wu Zetian de Huayan jing: Fowang chuantong yu fowang xingxiang.” Guoxue yanjiu 7 (2000): 279-321.
Liu, Ming-Wood. “The Harmonious Universe of Fa-tsang and Leibniz.” Philosophy East and West 32 (1982): 61-76.
Rothschild, Norman H. Sub-chapter “Fazang” in “Rhetoric, Ritual and Support Constituencies in the Political Authority of Wu Zhao, Woman Emperor of China.” Ph.D. dissertation, Brown University, 2003.
Weinstein, Stanley. “Imperial Patronage in T’ang Buddhism.” Perspectives on the T’ang, eds. Arthur F. Wright and Denis C. Pritchett (Yale University Press, 1973), 265-306.
Weinstein, Stanley. Buddhism in T’ang China. Cambridge University Press, 1987.
Wright, Dale. “The ‘Thought of Enlightenment’ In Fa-tsang’s Hua-yen Buddhism.” The Eastern Buddhist (Fall 2001): 97-106.

b. Primary Sources

Ch’oe Ch’iwŏn (Cui Zhiyuan), Da Tang Jianfusi gu shu fanjing dade Fazang heshang zhuan, (Taisho Tripitika, vol. 50, no. 2054).
- Biography.
Daoxuan, Xu Gaoseng zhuan (Biographies of Eminent Monks), Taisho Triptika, vol. 50, no. 2060.
- Biography.
Fazang, Dasheng qixinlun yiji, Taisho Tripitika vol. 44, no. 1846.
Fazang, Fanwang jing pusa jieben shu, Taisho Tripitika vol. 40, no. 1813.
- Commentary on Brahmajala sutra.
Fazang, Huayanjing tanxuan ji (Taisho Tripitika, vol. 35, no. 1733).
- Commentary on the profundities of the Flower Garland Sutra.
Fazang, Huayan jing wenyi gangmu, Taisho Tripitika, vol 35, no. 1734.
- Explicates the ten mysterious gates (Ten Mysteries) from the Flower Garland Sutra.
Fazang, Huayanjing zhigui (Taisho Tripitika, vol. 45, no. 1871).
- Commentary on the Flower Garland Sutra.
Fazang, Huayanjing zhuanji (Taisho Tripitika, vol. 51, no. 2073).
- Propaganda supporting Wu Zhao’s sovereignty written between 690 and 693.
Fazang, Huayan Wujiao zhang (Treatise of the Five Teachings), Taisho Tripitika, vol. 45, no, 1866.
- Central work that classifies Buddhist teachings and situates the Flower Garland Sutra at the apex.
Fazang, Jin shizi zhang, (Essay on the Golden Lion), Taisho Tripitika vol. 45, no. 1881.
Yan Chaoyin, “Da Tang Jianfusi gu dade Kangzang fashi zhi bei,” Taisho Tripitika, vol. 50, no. 2054.
- Funerary epitaph.
Zanning, Song Gaoseng zhuan, Taisho Tripitika, vol. 50, no. 2061.
Zhipan, Fozu tongji, Taisho Tripitika vol. 49, no. 2035.
- Biography is fascicle 29 of this Southern Song dynasty (1127-1279) work.

Author Information

Norman Harry Rothschild
Email: hrothsch@unf.edu
University of North Florida
U. S. A.

Epistemic Closure Principles

Epistemic closure principles state that the members of an epistemic set (such as propositions known by me) bear a given relation (such as known deductive entailment) only to other members of that epistemic set. The principle of the closure of knowledge under known logical entailment is that one knows everything that one knows to be logically entailed by something else one knows. For instance, if I know grass is green, and I know that grass is green deductively entails that grass is green or the sky is blue, then I know that grass is green or the sky is blue. Epistemic closure principles are employed in philosophy in myriad ways, but some theorists reject such principles, and they remain controversial.

Some people see closure principles as capturing the idea that we can add to our store of knowledge by accepting propositions entailed by what we know; others claim that this is a misunderstanding, and that closure principles are silent as to how a piece of knowledge is, or can be, acquired. For instance, the proposition I have a driver’s license issued by the state of North Carolina entails that North Carolina is not a mere figment of my imagination. According to the principle that knowledge is closed under known entailment, if I know the former claim, and I know the entailment, I know the latter claim. Some insist, however, that this must be distinguished from the (possibly) false claim that I could come to know the latter on the basis of my knowing the former, since my basis for knowing the former involves presupposing the latter (by taking my sense experience and memory at more or less face value, for instance).

Closure principles are employed in both skeptical and anti-skeptical arguments. The skeptic points out that if one knows an ordinary common sense proposition (such as that one has hands) to be true, and knows that this proposition entails the falsity of a skeptical hypothesis (such as that one is a handless brain in a vat, all of whose experiences are hallucinatory), one could know the falsity of the skeptical hypothesis, in virtue of knowledge being closed under known entailment. Since one cannot know the falsity of the skeptical hypothesis (or so the skeptic maintains), one also must not know the truth of the common sense claim that one has hands. Alternatively, the anti-skeptic might insist that we do know the truth of the common sense proposition, and hence, in virtue of the closure principle, we can know that the skeptical hypothesis is false. Although the closure principle is sometimes used by anti-skeptics, some view the rejection of closure as the key to refuting the skeptic.

The Closure of Knowledge under Known Entailment
Philosophical Uses of the Closure Principle
Externalist Accounts of Knowledge and the Rejection of Closure
Dogmatism and the Rejection of Closure
The McKinsey Paradox, Closure, and Transmission Failure
1. The McKinsey Paradox
2. Davies, Wright, and the Closure/Transmission Distinction
Ordinary Propositions, Lottery Propositions, and Closure
References and Further Reading
1. References
2. Further Reading

1. The Closure of Knowledge under Known Entailment

a. The Closure of Knowledge Under Entailment

A set is closed under a particular relation if all the members of the set bear the relation only to other members of the set. The set of true propositions is closed under entailment because true propositions entail only other truths. Since false propositions sometimes entail truths, false propositions are not closed under entailment. Epistemic closure principles state that members of an epistemic set (such as my justified beliefs) are closed under a given relation (which may be a non-epistemic relation, like entailment, or an epistemic one, such as known entailment).

A simple closure principle is the principle that knowledge is closed under entailment:

If a subject S knows that p, and p entails q, then S knows that q.

Less schematically, this says that if one knows one thing to be true and the known claim logically entails a second thing, then one knows the second thing to be true. This principle has obvious counter-examples. A complicated theorem of logic is entailed by anything (and hence by any proposition one knows), but one may not realize this and may thus fail to believe (or even grasp) the theorem. Since one must at least believe a proposition in order to know that it is true, we see that one may fail to know something entailed by something else that one knows. Additionally, even if a proposition is entailed by something one knows, if one comes to believe the proposition through some epistemically unjustified process, one will fail to know the proposition (since one’s belief of it will be unjustified). For instance, if one knows that one will start a new job today and then comes to believe that one will either start a new job today or meet a handsome stranger based on the testimony of her astrologist, then perhaps she will fail to know the truth of the entailed disjunction.

b. The Closure of Knowledge Under Known Entailment

It is more plausible that knowledge is closed under known entailment:

If S knows that p, and knows that p entails q, then S knows that q.

As stated, however, the principle seems vulnerable to counter-examples similar to the ones just discussed. The subject might fail to put his knowledge that p together with knowledge that p entails q and thus fail to infer q at all. One might know that she has ten fingers and that if she has ten fingers then the number of her fingers is not prime, but simply not bother to go on to deduce and form the belief that her number of fingers is not prime. Alternatively, although the subject could have come to believe q by inferring it correctly from something else that she knows (since she is aware of the entailment), she instead might have come to believe q through some other, epistemically unjustified, process.

How can we capture the idea that one can add to one’s store of knowledge by recognizing and assenting to what is entailed by what one already knows? This formulation seems suitably qualified:

If S knows that p, and comes to believe that q by correctly deducing it from her belief that p, then S knows that q.

Less formally, if I know one thing, correctly deduce another thing from it, and come to believe this second thing by so deducing it, then I know the second thing to be true. This principle eliminates counterexamples in which the subject fails to believe the entailed claim (and thus fails to know it) or comes to believe the entailed claim for bad reasons (and thus fails to know the claim). (Henceforth, uses in this article of the phrase “the principle of closure of knowledge under known entailment” should be regarded as referring to this preferred formulation of the principle).

So much is built into the antecedent of this principle that it might now seem trivial but, as we shall see, it has been disputed on various grounds.

c. Justification, Single-Premise and Multiple-Premise Closure

We would seem to have similar grounds for supposing that justified belief is closed under known entailment. One is epistemically justified in believing whatever one correctly deduces from one’s justified beliefs. This captures the idea that one way to add to one’s store of justified beliefs is to believe things entailed by your justified beliefs. When one reasons validly, the justification that one has for the premises carries over to the conclusion.

The mere fact that justification is (ordinarily taken to be) one of the necessary conditions for knowledge does not strictly entail that justification is closed under the same operations (such as known entailment) that knowledge is closed under. As Steven Hales (1995) has pointed out, to argue in this manner is to commit the fallacy of division: to infer from the fact that a whole thing has a particular quality, that each of its components must have this quality as well. For instance, it does not follow from the fact that the glee club is loud that each, or even any, of the individual singers in the glee club is loud. Knowledge might be closed under known entailment even if justified belief is not, if all the counterexamples to the closure of justification were examples in which the justified belief was missing at least one of the necessary conditions for knowledge. There seems to be no particular reason to believe that this is the case, however. (See Brueckner 2004 for more on this point).

The closure principles discussed thus far are instances of single premise closure. For instance, one’s knowledge that a given particular premise is true, when combined with a correct deduction from that premise of a conclusion, seems to guarantee that one knows the conclusion. There are also multiple premise closure principles. Here is an example:

If S knows that p and knows that q, and S comes to believe r by correctly deducing it from p and q, then S knows that r.

That is, if I know two things to be true and can deduce a third thing from the first two, then I know the third thing to be true. There is good reason to be dubious of multiple premise closure principles of justification, such as

If S is justified in believing that p and justified in believing that q, and S correctly deduces r from p and q, then S is justified in believing that r.

Lottery examples reveal the difficulty. Given that there are a million lottery tickets and that exactly one of them must win, it is plausible (though not obvious) that for any particular lottery ticket, I am justified in believing that it will lose. So I am justified in believing that ticket one will lose, that ticket two will lose, and so forth, for every ticket. But if I know that there are a million tickets, and I am justified in believing each of a million claims to the effect that ticket n will lose and I can correctly deduce from these claims that no ticket will win, then by closure I would be justified in concluding that no ticket will win, which by hypothesis is false. Justified belief is fallible, in that one can be justified in believing something even if there is a chance that one is mistaken; conjoin enough of the right sort of justified but fallible beliefs and the resulting conjunction will be unlikely to be true, and thus unjustified.

If knowledge, like justified belief, is fallible (say, only 99.9% certainty is required), then multiple premise closure principles for knowledge will fail as well. One could be sufficiently certain for knowledge about each of a thousand claims (“I will not die today”; “I will not die tomorrow”; …; “I will not die exactly 569 days from today”; etc.), but not sufficiently certain of the conjunction of these claims (“I will not die on any of the next thousand days”) in order to know it, even though it is jointly entailed by those thousand known claims (and thus true). The fallibility of knowledge is far more controversial than the fallibility of justified belief, however.

Similarly, closure might be thought to hold for different types of knowledge, such as a priori knowledge (i.e. knowledge not gotten through sense experience, to oversimplify a bit). If one knows a priori that p, and knows a priori that p entails q, then one knows a priori that q. Intuitively, it seems that if one knows the premises of an argument a priori and is able to validly deduce a conclusion from those premises, one would know the conclusion a priori as well. This last point is on weaker ground, however, as discussed in Section 5b.

2. Philosophical Uses of the Closure Principle

The closure principle, now qualified to handle the straightforward counterexamples, has been employed in skeptical and anti-skeptical arguments, in support of a dogmatic refusal pay attention to evidence that counts against what one knows, to generate a paradox about self-knowledge, and for many other philosophical ends. These uses are described in brief in this section, and in greater detail in later sections.

The skeptic may argue as follows:

I do not know that I am not a handless, artificially stimulated brain in a vat.
I do know that I have hands entails I am not a handless, artificially stimulated, brain in a vat.
If I know one thing, and I know that it entails a second thing, then I also know the second thing. (Closure)
Thus, I do not know that I have hands. (From 2 and 3, if I knew I had hands I would know that I am not a brain in a vat, in contradiction with 1).

If one really knew the ordinary common sense claim to be true, one could deduce the falsity of the skeptical claim from it and come to know that the skeptical claim is false (by closure). The fact that one cannot know that the skeptical claim is false (as per the first premise) demonstrates that one does not in fact know that the common sense proposition is true either. (See also Contemporary Skepticism).

But one person’s modus tollens (the inference from if p then q and not-q to the conclusion not-p) is another person’s modus ponens (the inference from if p then q and p to the conclusion q), as we can see from an anti-skeptical argument of the sort associated with G.E. Moore. (See Moore 1959).

I know that I have hands.
I know that I have hands entails I am not a handless, artificially stimulated, brain in a vat.
If I know one thing, and I know that it entails a second thing, then I also know the second thing. (Closure)
Thus, I know that I am not a handless, artificially stimulated brain in a vat.

From the fact that one knows that she has hands and this is incompatible with a skeptical hypothesis under which her hands are illusory, one can infer, and thus come to know (if closure is correct), the falsity of the skeptical hypothesis.

The closure principle can be used even in defense of a dogmatic rejection of any recalcitrant evidence that counts against something that one takes oneself to know. The argument runs as follows (adapted from Harman 1973):

I know my car is parked in Lot A. (Assume)
I know that if my car is parked in Lot A, and there is evidence that my car is not parked in Lot A (say, testimony that the car has been towed), then the evidence is misleading. (Analytic, since evidence against a truth must be misleading)
Thus, I know that any evidence that my car is not parked in Lot A is misleading. (Closure)
I know that there is evidence that my car is not parked in Lot A. (Assume)
Thus, I know that this evidence (testimony that my car was towed) is misleading. (Closure)
If a piece of evidence is known by me to be misleading, then I ought to disregard it. (Analytic)
Thus, I ought to disregard any evidence that my car is not parked in Lot A. (From 5 and 6)

This result seems paradoxical, however, as most would claim that it is epistemically irresponsible to ignore all the evidence against what one takes oneself to know, simply because it is evidence against what one takes oneself to know. It is plausible (though hardly obvious) that one takes oneself to know each thing that one believes (considered individually). If this is conjoined with the argument above, it entails that one ought to ignore any evidence against what one believes. This seems to be an even more ill-considered policy.

The closure principle also figures prominently in a paradox about self-knowledge and knowledge of the external world. It is now widely accepted that some thought contents are individuated externally. That is, there are some thought contents that one could not have unless one was in an environment or linguistic community that is a certain way. On this view, one could not think the thought that water is wet were one not in an environment with water, or at least with some causal connection to water. Given content externalism, it seems we may argue as follows (the argument is due to McKinsey 1991):

I know that I have mental property M (say, the thought that water is wet). (Assume privileged access to one’s own thoughts)
I know that if I have mental property M (the thought that water is wet), then I meet external conditions E (say, living in an environment containing water). (Externalism with respect to content)
If I know one thing, and I know that it entails a second thing, then I know the second thing. (The principle of the closure of knowledge under known entailment).
Thus, I know that I meet external conditions E (namely, that I live in environs containing water). (From 1, 2 and 3)

The conclusion follows from an application of the closure principle, but what makes this paradoxical is that it appears that the knowledge that is attributed in the premises depends on reflection alone (introspection plus a priori reasoning), whereas the knowledge attributed in the conclusion is empirical. If the premises are correct, and closure holds, I can know an empirical fact by reflection alone (since I know it on the basis of premises than can be known by reflection alone). Something seems to have gone wrong and it is unclear which premise, if any, is the culprit.

Closure principles figure in another philosophical puzzle about knowledge of “ordinary propositions”, those we ordinarily take ourselves to know, and “lottery propositions,” those that, although extremely likely, we do not ordinarily take ourselves to know. Suppose that one is struggling to get by on a pensioner’s income. It seems plausible to say that one knows one will not be able to afford a mansion on the French Riviera this year. However, that one will not be able to afford the mansion this year entails that one will not win the lottery. By the closure principle, since one knows that one will not be able to afford the mansion, and knows that this entails that one will not win the lottery, one must know that one will not win the lottery. However, very few are inclined at accept that one knows one will not win the lottery. After all, there’s a chance one could win.

3. Externalist Accounts of Knowledge and the Rejection of Closure

a. Epistemic Externalism and Internalism

To determine whether someone is epistemically justified in believing something, one must do so from a particular point of view. One may consider the point of the view of the agent who holds the belief or of someone who possesses all the relevant information (which may be unavailable to the agent). To oversimplify, those who consider only the subject’s perspective when evaluating the subject’s epistemic justification are epistemic internalists, and those who adopt the point of view of one with all the relevant information are epistemic externalists. An account of epistemic justification is internalist if it requires that all the elements necessary for an agent’s belief to be epistemically justified are cognitively accessible to the agent; that is, these elements (say, evidence or reasons) must be internal to the agent’s perspective. Externalist theories of justification, on the other hand, allow that some of the elements necessary for epistemic justification (such as a belief’s being produced by a process that makes it objectively likely to be true) may be cognitively inaccessible to the agent and external to the agent’s perspective.

There are so many varieties of internalism and externalism that further generalization is perilous. Considering the theories’ respective treatments of the problem of induction illustrates the basic difference between them. Hume famously argued that although we rely on inductive inferences, we have access to no non-question begging justification for doing so, as our only grounds for thinking that induction will continue to be reliable is that it always has been reliable. This is an inductive justification of the belief that induction is epistemically justified. If Hume is right, then a typical internalist will concede that beliefs based on inductive reasoning are not epistemically justified. An externalist, however, might insist that such beliefs are justified, provided that inductive reasoning as a matter of fact is a process that reliably produces mostly true beliefs, whether the agent who reasons inductively has access to that fact or not. On the other hand, an epistemic internalist might rate the beliefs of a brain in a vat or a victim of Cartesian evil demon deception as epistemically justified, provided that they were formed in a way that seems reasonable from the point of the view of the agent (the brain in a vat), such as through the careful consideration of evidence (evidence, albeit, that is misleading). The epistemic externalist, however, likely would rate such an agent’s beliefs as unjustified, on the basis of evidence not accessible to the agent, such as that the belief-forming processes she relies on make her beliefs extremely likely to be false.

For the most part, internalist accounts of knowledge are those that appeal to an internalist conception of epistemic justification and externalist accounts of knowledge employ an externalist conception of justification. (Alternatively, one may be an internalist about justification and an externalist about knowledge, by rejecting the view that epistemic justification is one of the requirements for knowledge.) Perhaps the greatest challenge to closure principles for knowledge comes from externalist theories of knowledge, notably those of Robert Nozick and Fred Dretske.

b. Nozick’s Tracking Account of Knowledge and the Failure of Closure

It strikes many that some version of the closure principle must be true. The idea that no version of the principle is true is, according to one noted epistemologist, “one of the least plausible ideas to come down the philosophical pike in recent years.” (Feldman 1995) Nevertheless, philosophers have argued against the epistemic closure principle on many different grounds. One serious challenge to closure arose from those who proposed the “tracking” analysis of knowledge (notably Nozick 1981). According to the tracking theory, to know that p is to track the truth of p. That is, one’s true belief that p is knowledge if and only if the following two conditions hold: if p were not the case, one would not believe that p, and if p were the case, one would believe that p. For one’s belief that p to be knowledge, one’s belief must be sensitive to the truth or falsity of p; that sensitivity is captured by the two subjunctive conditions above. One knows that Albany is the capital of New York only if one would not believe it if it were false, and would believe it if it were true. (See also Robert Nozick’s epistemology).

This is an externalist theory of knowledge because whether or not an agent satisfies the subjunctive conditions for knowledge may not be cognitively accessible to the agent. To evaluate an agent’s belief, with respect to whether it meets those conditions, it may be necessary to adopt the point of view of someone with information not accessible to the agent.

Let’s illustrate this with an example similar to Nozick’s own (1981, 207). Let p be the belief that one is sitting in a chair in Jerusalem. Let q be the belief that one’s brain is not floating in a tank on Alpha Centauri, being artificially stimulated so as to make one believe one is sitting in a chair in Jerusalem. Suppose one has a true belief that p. In the “closest” counterfactual situations (to employ the terminology of one account of truth-conditions for subjunctives) in which p is false (say, one is standing in Jerusalem, or one is sitting in Tel Aviv), one will not believe p. In close counterfactual situations in which one is sitting in Jerusalem, one does believe that p. One’s belief of p tracks the truth of p and thus counts as knowledge.

Suppose, on the other hand, that one has a true belief that q. If one’s belief that q were false, however (and one really was in this predicament on Alpha Centauri), one would still believe (falsely) that one was not in Alpha Centauri (q). One’s belief that q, while actually true, does not track the truth of q (being held when q is true but not when q is false). Hence, the belief that q does not count as knowledge.

How does this relate to the closure of knowledge? The proposition that one is sitting in Jerusalem (p) entails that one’s brain is not floating in a tank in Alpha Centauri, being stimulated so as to make one think that one is sitting in Jerusalem (q). We may suppose that one can correctly deduce q from p. Even so, since one’s belief that p tracks the truth of p and counts as knowledge and one’s belief that q does not do so, knowledge fails to be closed under known entailment. One may know that p, and know that p entails q (and come to believe the latter by correctly deducing it from the former), and yet fail to know that q.

Nozick’s account has at least two virtues. One is that the tracking analysis of knowledge is plausible. The other is that the rejection of closure allows us to reconcile the following two claims, both of which seem plausible but had seemed incompatible: (1) we do know many common sense propositions, such as that I have hands, and (2) we do not know that skeptical hypotheses, such as that I am a handless, artificially stimulated brain in a vat, are false. One desideratum of a theory of knowledge is that it refutes skepticism while accounting for the plausibility and persuasiveness of the skeptic’s case against common sense knowledge claims. Both the skeptic and the Moorean anti-skeptic come up short here. The skeptic must deny our common sense knowledge claims and the Moorean must maintain that we can know the falsity of skeptical hypotheses. As long as we accept the closure principle, whether we are skeptics or anti-skeptics, we cannot maintain both that we know common sense propositions and that we do not know that the skeptical hypotheses are false, since we know that the common sense propositions entail the falsity of the skeptical propositions. Knowledge of the truth of the common sense claims would, if knowledge is closed under known entailment, guarantee our knowledge that skeptical hypotheses are false. Citing our failure to know that skeptical hypotheses are false, the skeptic applies modus tollens and infers that we must not know the common sense propositions. The rejection of closure blocks this move by the skeptic.

This is not to say that there are not plausible counterexamples to the tracking account of knowledge. I may know my mother is not the assassin since she was with me when the assassination took place. But counterfactually, if she were the assassin, I would still believe she was not, since after all I couldn’t believe such a thing of my mother. My belief that my mother is not the assassin fails to track the truth, since I would have believed it even if it were false, but it seems quite plausible that I do know she’s not the assassin, as my evidence for her innocence is quite overwhelming – my mother cannot be in two places at once. Tracking accounts like Nozick’s, which do not make reference to the reasons the agent has for the belief in question, seem vulnerable to such counterexamples.

c. Dretske’s Externalist Account of Knowledge and Closure Failure

Dretske’s account of knowledge is as follows: one’s true belief that p on the basis of reason R is knowledge that p if only if (i) one’s belief that p is based on R and (ii) R would not hold if p were false. Less formally, we may put this as follows: one knows a given claim to be true only if one has a reason to believe that it is true, and one would not have this reason to believe it if it were not true. (See Dretske 1971). This is an externalist account because whether an agent meets conditions (i) and (ii) above may be inaccessible to the agent. One could believe a claim on the basis of a particular reason without being able to explain one’s reliance on that reason, and without knowing whether one would still have the reason if the claim were false. For instance, one might believe that one’s toes are curled on the basis of proprioceptive evidence (evidence that one would not have if one’s toes were not curled), without one having any idea what proprioception is, what sort of evidence one has for the claim that one’s toes are curled, or whether one would have such evidence even if one’s toes were uncurled.

Let’s illustrate Dretske’s account with his famous zebra example (Dretske 1970). Suppose one is in front of the zebra display at the zoo. One believes that one is seeing zebras on the basis of perceptual evidence. Furthermore, in the closest possible worlds in which one is not seeing zebras (where the display is of camels or tigers), one would not have that perceptual evidence. Consequently, one knows that one is now seeing zebras, on the basis of the perceptual evidence one is having. Consider, however, the belief that one is not now seeing mules cleverly disguised by zoo staff to resemble zebras. Whatever one’s reason for believing this claim (say, that it is just very unlikely that the zoo would deceive people in that fashion), one would still have this reason even if the belief were false (and one was seeing mules cleverly disguised to look like zebras). Hence, one would not know that one is not now seeing mules cleverly disguised to resemble zebras.

As with Nozick’s account, this provides a counterexample to the closure of knowledge. One can know that one is now seeing zebras, one can correctly deduce from this that one is not now seeing mules cleverly disguised to resemble zebras, and yet fail to know that one is not now seeing mules cleverly disguised to resemble zebras. Furthermore, Dretske’s account better handles the counterexample to Nozick’s theory. One believes (truly) that one’s mother is not the assassin, on the grounds that one was with one’s mother at the time the assassination happened (and that mother cannot be in two places at once) and one would not have this reason to think mother innocent if she were indeed the assassin. Thus, one knows that one’s mother is not the assassin, since the evidence is absolutely conclusive, despite the fact that if one’s mother were the assassin, one would still believe that she wasn’t, on the basis of a different, bad reason.

Even Dretske’s account is plausibly vulnerable to counterexample. Suppose that one believes correctly at noon on Tuesday that Jones is chair of one’s department, on the basis of the typical sort of evidence (say, recollection of Jones being installed in the position, the department’s website listing Jones as chair, and so forth). Suppose that at five minutes past noon on Tuesday, Jones is suddenly struck dead by a bolt of lightning (and is consequently no longer chair). Did one know at noon, five minutes prior to the death, that Jones was the chair? Since one would have had that same set of reasons to believe at noon that Jones was chair even in the closest possible worlds in which he was not chair at noon (that is, worlds in which he’d been struck dead by lightning five minutes before noon), one does not actually know at noon that Jones is the chair. Those who find this verdict implausible (that is, those who think one does know on the basis of the typical evidence that Jones is the chair, right up until the moment that Jones suddenly is struck dead and stops being the chair), may find Dretske’s account of knowledge wanting. (The example is adapted from Brueckner and Fiocco 2002).

Further justification of Dretske’s for denying closure is that there are other sentential operators that are not closed under known entailment and behave in many respects like the knowledge operator. (See Dretske 1970). Dretske defines a sentential operator O to be fully penetrating when O(p) is closed under known entailment. That is, O is penetrating if and only if: O(p) entails O(q) if p is known to entail q. “It is true that” is a penetrating operator, since, if p is known to entail q, “it is true that p” must entail “it is true that q”. “It is surprising that” is non-penetrating; although it is surprising that tomatoes are growing on the apple tree, it is not surprising that something is growing on the apple tree. Some operators are semi-penetrating. An operator is semi-penetrating when it penetrates only to a certain subset of a given proposition’s entailments.

For instance, “R is an explanatory reason for” seems to be a semi-penetrating operator. Within a range of cases, if p is known to entail q, then R is an explanatory reason for p entails R is an explanatory reason for q. A reason that explains why Bill and Harold are invited to every party necessarily is a reason why Harold is invited to every party. Similarly, “knows that” seems to penetrate through similar entailments; if one knows that Bill and Harold are invited to every party, then one knows that Harold is invited to every party.

However, “R is an explanatory reason for my painting the walls green” need not entail “R is an explanatory reason for my painting the walls.” Depending on the context, a reason that explains why I painted my walls green may be a reason why I did something entailed by my painting the walls green, such as my not painting the walls red, but may not be a reason why I did something else entailed by my painting the walls green, such as my not wallpapering the walls green. The emphasis is crucial. A reason to paint the walls green is a reason not to paint them red, but may not be a reason to paint rather than wallpaper. A reason to paint the walls green may be a reason not to paint the floor green, but it might be neutral as to the color. Consideration of ordinary demands for reasons shows that emphasis, or other contextual factors, determines a certain range of reasons to be relevant and a certain range irrelevant. The same reason will not suffice to explain each of the following: “I bought tomatoes,” “I bought tomatoes” and “I bought tomatoes”, even though these three sentences entail and are entailed by exactly the same claims, since they are logically equivalent. Dretske says that no fact is an island and that various contextual factors will determine, for each operator, its relevant alternatives (i.e. the negations of the consequents to which the operator penetrates). (See also Contextualism in Epistemology, Chapter 3, on Dretske and the denial of closure).

d. “Abominable Conjunctions”

On the other hand, some philosophers view the closure principle as so obviously true that, rather than reject it to accommodate a given theory of knowledge, they would reject the account of knowledge in order to keep closure. Dretske’s account of knowledge has been much discussed in the philosophical literature. One consequence of this rejection of closure in favor of his account that hardly seems felicitous is that one could truly say, “I know that that animal is a zebra and I know that zebras are not mules, but I don’t know that that animal is not a cleverly disguised mule.” Or, “I know I have hands, and I know that if I have hands I am not handless, but I don’t know that I am not a handless brain in a vat.” Worse yet, “I know it is not a mule, but I don’t know it’s not a cleverly disguised mule.” These claims (“abominable conjunctions,” according to DeRose 1995) sound at best paradoxical and at worst absurd. This seems to point to the extreme plausibility of some form or another of the closure principle.

Dretske (2005a, 17-18) agrees that such statements sound absurd, but maintains that they are true. They may violate conventional conversational expectations and they may be met with incomprehension, but they are not self-contradictory. “Empty” and “flat” are often taken to be absolute concepts (since to be empty is to not contain anything at all and to be flat is to have no bumps), but also context-relative, in that whether a particular item counts as a thing or a bump depends on the context. It sounds a bit strange to say that the warehouse is empty, but has lots of dust, gas molecules, and empty crates in it. The utterance may violate conversational rules, but the utterance might, despite all that, be true, if the concepts of emptiness and flatness are as described. So too with the abominable conjunctions if the attendant conception of knowledge is correct. Philosophers may always appeal to Gricean conversational implicatures to blunt the objection that their view entails absurd claims. Truth and conversational propriety are not one and the same. (Paul Grice is the philosopher most closely associated with the view that communication is guided by various conversational maxims and that some utterances are conversationally inappropriate, even if true, because they invite misunderstanding. For instance, the utterance “Mary insulted her boss and she was fired,” is true even if Mary did not insult her boss until after she was fired, but it would be an inappropriate remark in most contexts, since the listener naturally would conclude that the insult preceded the dismissal. For more on this, see Grice 1989).

John Hawthorne (2005: 30-31) makes two points in reply. First, he says, it is unclear what sort of Gricean mechanism could make it true but conversationally inappropriate to utter “S knew that p and correctly deduced q from p, but did not know that q.” Second, an appeal of this sort can at best explain why we do not utter certain true propositions, but not why we actually believe their negations. Even if it is true that one’s wife is his best friend, it would be inappropriate for him to introduce her to someone as his best friend. But the conversational mechanism at play here could hardly be an explanation for why he believed that his wife was not his best friend (even though she was). Why, if the denial of closure is true but conversationally infelicitous, do so many not only not deny closure in conversations but in fact believe that the closure principle is true?

One might reply that many people, even philosophers, are apt in some situations to mistake what is conversationally appropriate for what is true (as with conditional claims that have false antecedents), so an explanation of why a true claim violates conversational norms might well explain why people believe the negation of the claim.

e. Alternative Anti-Skeptical Strategies Need Not Reject Closure

There are alternative strategies for refuting skepticism that seem to have many of the virtues of the tracking account of knowledge, but do not entail the falsity of closure principles. Contextualism, for example, says that knowledge attributions are sensitive to context, in that a subject S might know a proposition p relative to one context, but simultaneously fail to know that p relative to another context. The contextual factors to which knowledge attributions are taken to be sensitive include things like whether a particular doubt has been raised or acknowledged and the importance of the belief being correct.

In an ordinary context, where skeptical scenarios have not been raised, the standards for knowledge are quite low, but, in contexts in which skeptical doubts have been raised, such as an epistemology class, standards for knowledge have been raised to levels that typically cannot be met. One might know relative to the everyday context that she has hands, but fail to know this relative to the skeptic’s context, because a skeptical scenario has been raised and she cannot rule it out.

Or a true belief with a certain level of justification might count as knowledge as long as it is not terribly important that the belief be correct, but would no longer be knowledge if the stakes were raised. One might know that the bank will be open on Saturday after confirming that the bank has Saturday hours, even if one has not checked whether the bank has changed its hours in the past two weeks, as long as no great harm will befall one if it turns out one is wrong. But if financial ruin will befall one were a check not deposited before Monday, then one’s justification might need to be stronger before it would be correct to say that one knows the bank is open Saturday.

The contextualist then can reconcile the intuitions that it is sometimes correct to attribute to someone knowledge of everyday common sense propositions, despite her inability to rule out skeptical propositions, and that we are sometimes correct in refusing to attribute knowledge of the falsity of a skeptical scenario when the subject is unable to rule out such scenarios. But the contextualist can do this while accepting at least some version of closure. The contextualist says that epistemic closure holds within an epistemic context, but fails inter-contextually. For instance, in the everyday, low epistemic standards context, one knows that one has hands and anything that one can correctly deduce from this claim, such as that one is not a handless being deceived into thinking that one has hands. In the context with much higher epistemic standards, one knows neither that one is not a handless, artificially stimulated brain in a vat, nor (by an application of the closure of knowledge under known entailment) that one has hands. Closure will fail only when it extends across contexts. For instance, if one were to cite one’s knowledge that one has hands (in the ordinary context) as grounds for saying in the heightened context that one knows that the brain in a vat hypothesis is false (as the Moorean might), one would illegitimately apply the closure principle. The skeptic’s citing one’s failure to know the falsity of the skeptical hypothesis (in the heightened context) as entailing that one does not know the common sense proposition (in the ordinary context) would be a similar misuse of the closure principle.

If a theory of knowledge is independently plausible and can answer the skeptic without denying closure, then, everything else being equal, we ought to be reluctant to reject closure just so that we can accept the tracking account of knowledge. Contextualism, of course, is plagued with problems of its own. One such problem is as follows: since whether one knows a claim or not depends on how stringent the epistemic standards are in the context and the standards can be raised by a particular doubt occurring to someone in the context, contextualism seems to imply that it is easier to know things if one spends time with the stupid or incurious or if one is stupid or incurious.

The plausibility of the denial of closure may well depend not only on whether it is a way to avoid skepticism, but on whether it is the only way to do so. (Dretske does insist that the only plausible way to refute skepticism is by denying closure. See his 2005a and 2005b for a defense of this claim, trenchant criticisms of the contextualist theory, and responses to criticisms of the tracking theory.)

f. Some Skeptical Arguments do not Employ Closure

One of the strengths claimed for the tracking account of knowledge is that it blocks the standard skeptical argument, since it involves the rejection of closure. Not all skeptical arguments employ closure principles, however, so it is unclear how much anti-skeptical value would accrue from denying closure. Underdetermination arguments might be the best skeptical arguments and they do not depend (at least explicitly) on closure.

Underdetermination is a relation that holds between two or more theories, when the theories are incompatible, but empirically equivalent. Underdetermination skeptical arguments rely crucially on the premise that if two theories are incompatible but compatible with all the available (and perhaps possible) data, we cannot know that one is true and the other false. Compare, for example, the thesis that I have hands, which I perceive through sense perception, and the thesis that I am a handless brain in a vat, artificially stimulated so as to have misleading sense perceptions. These theses are incompatible, but they are empirically equivalent. Whichever thesis were true, I would have the same sort of experiences. Suppose we adopt the following principle: if two incompatible theses both entail (or predict) the same observational data, then that observational data does not support (or justify belief of) one of the theses over the other. With this principle and the premise that the two theses are incompatible but observationally equivalent, we can deduce that our apparent perception of our hands does not justify us in believing that we have hands.

The argument is greatly oversimplified, but the outline of the skeptical argument from underdetermination now ought to be clear. The argument does not explicitly employ any closure premise, so the rejection of closure would seem not to undermine the argument in any straightforward way. One could always argue that the appeal of the argument from underdetermination implicitly relies on the closure principle or that the argument from underdetermination is objectionable on other grounds. Skeptical arguments from underdetermination, however, seem as plausible as other skeptical arguments and their plausibility seems not to depend on the plausibility of any of the closure principles.

Infinite regress arguments for skepticism also do not straightforwardly appeal to closure. A regress argument that no belief is epistemically justified (and hence than no belief counts as knowledge) runs as follows. We assume that all justification is inferential. That is, every justified belief is justified by appeal to some other justified belief. The basis for this claim might be the nature of argumentation. One is justified in believing a conclusion if one is justified in believing the premises that support the conclusion. If the conclusion is one of the premises, then the argument is question-begging, or circular, and not rationally persuasive. But if every justified belief can be justified only be inferring it from some further justified belief and there cannot be an infinite regress of justified beliefs, then it must be that no beliefs are justified. (A foundationalist about justification, on the other hand, while agreeing that an infinite regress of justified beliefs is impossible, insists that there are justified beliefs, and hence that some beliefs are justified non-inferentially, or in other words, that some justified beliefs are basic or foundational). The claim that no justified belief is self-justifying does not entail any closure principle of justification or knowledge, so the argument seems to be independent of closure and thus not vulnerable to arguments against closure principles. (See also Ancient Skepticism).

The proponent of the tracking account of knowledge need not answer all forms of the skeptical argument with the same tools, so even if some skeptical arguments do not depend on the closure principle, the tracking analysis might provide the resources for countering the skeptical arguments from underdetermination or regress.

4. Dogmatism and the Rejection of Closure

At least one philosopher (Audi 1988, 76-8; 1991, 77-84) has claimed that the justification of dogmatism, adapted from Harman (see section 2 of this article), is a reductio ad absurdum of the epistemic closure principle. If closure allows one to infer, and thus know, that any evidence against something one knows must be misleading and may be ignored, then closure must be rejected.

Audi’s example is of a man who adds up a series of numbers and thereby knows the sum of the numbers. But the man’s wife (whom he considers to be a better mathematician) says that he has added the numbers incorrectly and gotten the wrong sum. If the man knows that the sum is n, and knows that his wife says the sum is not n, then by closure he knows that his wife is wrong. (This is so, as “the sum is n and my wife says the sum in not n” entails that “my wife is wrong;” one knows the former claim and knows it entails the latter, so one knows the latter). Since he knows his wife is wrong, there is no need to recalculate the sum. (Similar examples appear in Dretske 1970 and Thalberg 1974). If one believes something only when one takes oneself to know it, as is plausible, then by this reasoning one has reason to dismiss any evidence against something that one believes.

Denying the closure principle to avoid the odd dogmatic conclusion has some initial appeal, but there are alternative solutions that do not require us to reject such a compelling principle. And, as Feldman says (1995, 493), there is a general reason not to resolve the paradox by denying closure. To say, “Yes, I know that p is true, and that p entails q, but I draw the line at q,” seems irrational. To refuse to accept what you know to be the consequences of your beliefs, he says, is to be “patently unreasonable.” Not only is it infelicitous to deny closure, but the dogmatist argument may be blocked without doing so.

For instance, one could take the dogmatism argument to be a reductio ad absurdum of the anti-skeptical position. This is the tack taken by Peter Unger (1975). If we deny that one could know that p (say, that the sum of the numbers is n), then even if we accept closure, we have no reason to suppose that one could know that all evidence against p was misleading.

Alternatively, Roy Sorensen (Sorensen 1988) argues that given that one knows that p, the conditional “If E is evidence against p, then E is misleading” is a junk conditional, in that although it may be known to be true, this knowledge cannot be expanded under modus ponens. That is to say, if “if p then q” is a junk conditional, the conditional can be known to be true, but it could not be the case that simultaneously the conditional is known and that knowledge of the antecedent p would justify one in believing the consequent q. Some conditionals are known to be true on the basis of the extreme unlikelihood of the antecedent, but are such that if one acquired evidence that supports the antecedent, one would not be justified in inferring the consequent because the probability of the antecedent is inversely proportional to the probability of the conditional. That is, if one were to learn that the antecedent of the conditional was true, one would no longer have reason to accept (and would no longer know) the conditional. “If this is a Cuban cigar, then I’m a monkey’s uncle!” is an example of such a conditional. This conditional can be known to be true, in virtue of the antecedent being known to be false, but if one were to find evidence that this is indeed a Cuban cigar, one should not infer that he is a monkey’s uncle. Rather, one should conclude that perhaps one did not know the conditional to be true after all, since one has evidence that its antecedent was true and its consequent false. In short, if a conditional is a junk conditional one cannot come to know the consequent q in virtue of one’s knowing the antecedent p and the conditional if p then q, because one’s knowledge of the conditional depends on the falsity of the antecedent.

Given that one knows that r (say, that one’s car is in parking lot A), one knows that the conditional “if there is any evidence against r, however strong, then it must be misleading” is true. Part of one’s basis for knowing that r might be that one has reason to believe that there is no strong evidence against r. But if one were to learn of strong evidence against r, such as testimony that one’s car had been towed, one ought, at least in some cases, to consider the possibility that one does not in fact know that r, rather than simply inferring that the testimony is misleading. Learning the truth of the antecedent – that there is strong evidence against r – may undermine the justification for believing the conditional itself, thus making the conditional resistant to modus ponens. Knowledge of the conditional depends on one’s knowing that the antecedent is false. Finding evidence in favor of the antecedent – even if in fact it is misleading – may weaken one’s justification for the conditional, such that one no longer knows the conditional to be true.

This blocking of the dogmatist argument does not involve denying closure, though. The reason the modus ponens inference fails to go through is because the conditional is a “junk” conditional; one can know the conditional to be true only if one does not know the antecedent to be true, and the closure principle applies only if one simultaneously knows both the conditional and its antecedent to be true.

Another explanation that does not require the denial of closure is due to Michael Veber (Veber 2004). He says that even if the dogmatist argument is sound, the principle “If a piece of evidence E is known by S to be misleading, S ought to disregard it,” ought not to be endorsed on grounds of human fallibility. We are frequently enough wrong in taking ourselves to know what we in fact do not know that following such a principle would lead one to disregard evidence that is not misleading. There is nothing wrong with the principle, provided it is correctly applied; but due to the difficulty or impossibility of correctly applying it, adopting such a policy is contraindicated.

5. The McKinsey Paradox, Closure, and Transmission Failure

a. The McKinsey Paradox

Michael McKinsey (1991) discovered a paradox about content externalism that has prompted some reconsideration of how knowledge is transmitted through deductive reasoning.

Content externalism (or anti-individualism) is, to greatly oversimplify, the thesis that we are only able to have thoughts with certain contents because we inhabit environments of certain sorts. (Putnam 1975 and Burge 1979 are the most notable defenses of this view). Molecule-for-molecule duplicates could differ in their contents due to differences in their environments. According to the externalist, my twin on Twin Earth might be an exact duplicate of me, but if Twin Earth contains a different but similar light metal used to make baseball bats, cans, and so forth instead of aluminum, then even if the denizens of Twin Earth call this metal “aluminum,” their thoughts are not thoughts about aluminum. This view is a repudiation of the Cartesian view of the mental, according to which the contents of our thoughts are what they are independent of the surrounding world.

Externalism has been defended and criticized on many different grounds, but the debate about externalism has pivoted largely on its implications for the thesis that we have privileged access to the contents of our own thoughts. How does one know that she is now thinking that some cans are made from aluminum, rather than the thought that some cans are made from twaluminum (as we may call it), which is what she would be thinking if she lived on Twin Earth? Incompatibilists about externalism and privileged access point out that the two thoughts are introspectively indiscriminable if externalism is true and argue that one could only know which of these thoughts one is now thinking through empirical investigation of one’s environment.

Compatibilists about externalism and self-knowledge often argue that if a subject has a mental state with a particular content (say, a belief that some cans are made of aluminum) in virtue of that subject bearing a certain relation to an external state of affairs (say, aluminum, rather than twaluminum, being present in one’s environs), then any mental state the subject has about that particular mental state of his, like his belief that he believes some cans are made of aluminum, will also stand in a similar relation to the same external state of affairs (aluminum, rather than twaluminum, being present). Hence, this second-order mental state (i.e. a mental state about a mental state) will involve the same content as the first-order belief (say, that some cans are made of aluminum). In short, one will believe that he believes cans are made of aluminum only if one in fact does believe that cans are made of aluminum, since both of these states bear a causal relation to aluminum, rather than twaluminum. (See Burge 1988 and Heil 1988). Whatever makes it the case that S thinks that p (instead of q) will also make it the case that S thinks I am thinking that p (instead of I am thinking that q). Coupled with a reliabilist theory of knowledge, these second-order beliefs count as knowledge since they cannot go wrong and the thesis of privileged access is reconciled with externalism.

Enter McKinsey’s Paradox. We assume that we know content externalism to be true and that it is compatible with a suitably robust thesis of privileged access to thought contents. We may now reason as follows:

I know that I am in mental state M (say, the state of believing that water is wet). (Privileged Access)
I know that if I am in mental state M, then I meet external conditions E (say, living in an environment that contains water). (Content Externalism, known through philosophical reflection)
If I know one thing and I know that it entails a second thing, then I know the second thing. (Closure of knowledge under known entailment)
Thus, I know that I meet external conditions E. (From 1-3)

The knowledge attributed in the premises is a priori in the broad sense that includes knowledge gotten through introspection and/or philosophical reflection. That knowledge is not gained via empirical investigation of the external world. The conclusion follows by an application of the closure principle. What is paradoxical is that, given closure, it seems that one can know the truth of an empirical claim about the external world (say, that one’s environment contains water or that it contains aluminum rather than twaluminum) simply by inferring it from truths known by reflection or introspection. This argument bolsters the incompatibilist’s case: since it is only by investigation of the world that one can know that one meets a particular set of external conditions and since the premises (including closure) entail that this fact can be known on the basis of knowledge not dependent on investigation of the world, either the privileged access premise or the externalist thesis must be false (provided that the closure principle is correct).

b. Davies, Wright, and the Closure/Transmission Distinction

There are many responses to this argument. Some reject externalism, some (like McKinsey) deny privileged access, and some compatibilists (Brueckner 1992) argue that even if externalism is known to be true, nothing as specific as the second premise of the argument could be known a priori. But perhaps the most influential attempt to solve the paradox is due to Martin Davies (1998) and Crispin Wright (2000). They argue that even though arguments like McKinsey’s are valid and their premises are known to be true, this knowledge is not transmitted across the entailment to the conclusion. At first blush, it seems like Davies and Wright are rejecting closure, which is certainly one way to deal with the paradox. Davies and Wright accept closure, though, and only reject a related but stronger epistemological principle that says that knowledge is transmitted over known entailment.

Davies and Wright are distinguishing between the closure of knowledge under known entailment and what they take to be a common misreading of it. The closure principle says that if one knows that p and knows that p entails q, then one knows that q, but the principle is silent on what one’s basis or justification for q is and does not claim that the basis for q is the knowledge that p and that p entails q. The principle of the transmission of knowledge under known entailment, however, states that if one knows that p, and knows that p entails q, then one knows q on that basis – what enables one to know that p and that p entails q also enables one to know that q. Davies and Wright accept the closure principle but deny the transmission principle, arguing that it fails when the inference from p to q is, although valid, not cogent. Here cogency is understood as an argument’s aptness for producing rational conviction.

One way an argument could be valid but fail to be cogent is that the justification for the premises presupposes the truth of the conclusion. If I reason from the premise that I have a drivers license issued by the state of North Carolina (based on visual inspection of my license and memory of having obtained it at the North Carolina Department of Motor Vehicles) to the conclusion that there exists an external world, including North Carolina, outside my mind, it is plausible that my justification for the premise (taking sense experience and memory at face value) presupposes the truth of the conclusion. If this is so, then it seems that the premise could not be my basis for knowing the conclusion. Anyone in doubt about the conclusion would not accept the premise, so although the premise entails the conclusion, the premise could not provide the basis for rational conviction that the conclusion is true. Such an argument is valid, but not cogent. It would not be a counterexample to closure, for anyone who knows the premise and the entailment also must know the conclusion, but it is a counterexample to the transmission principle, since the conclusion would not be known on the basis of the knowledge of the premise.

According to Davies and Wright, the McKinsey argument is valid but not cogent because knowledge of the conclusion is presupposed in one’s supposed introspective knowledge of the premises. Thus, it is a counterexample to transmission, but poses no threat to closure. The non-empirical access to the externally individuated thought contents is conditional on the assumption that certain external conditions obtain (such as that one’s environs include aluminum rather than twaluminum), which can only be confirmed empirically. Thus one may not reason from the non-empirical knowledge claimed in the premises to non-empirical knowledge of an empirical truth that enjoys presuppositional status with regard to the premises. That one has a thought about water may entail that one bears a causal relation to water in one’s environment (if externalism is correct) and one may know the former and the entailment only if one knows the latter, but one may not cogently reason from the premise to the conclusion, since the inference begs the question. Anyone who doubts the conclusion of the McKinsey argument in the first place would not (or at least should not — the presuppositions of our premises are not always recognized as such) be moved to accept the premises that entail it.

Consider then the following principle about a priori knowledge:

(APK) If a subject knows something a priori and correctly deduces (a priori) from it a second thing, then the subject knows a priori the second claim.

We can describe this principle in two equivalent ways. It is the principle of closure of a priori knowledge under correct a priori deduction and, alternatively, it is a specific instance of the principle of transmission of knowledge under known entailment, since it claims that the a priori basis for knowledge of the premise transmits to the conclusion, allowing it to be known a priori as well. If Davies and Wright are correct, the principle is false because counterexamples may be found in deductions that are valid but not cogent.

Davies and Wright apply this distinction between transmission and closure to Moore’s anti-skeptical argument as well. Although it is true that the negation of the brain-in-a-vat hypothesis is entailed by an ordinary proposition, such as that I have hands, the existence of the external world is presupposed in the justification for that premise and, therefore, may not be justifiably inferred from that premise. Moore’s argument is not cogent, so it is a counterexample to transmission, which we have reason to reject anyhow, and not a counterexample to closure (or so Davies and Wright argue).

This is plausibly another sort of conditional that is not expandable by modus ponens. Unlike the junk conditionals, which cannot be expanded because the conditional can be known to be true only when the antecedent of the conditional is not known to be true, conditionals in which the justification for the antecedent presupposes justification for the consequent – we may call them conditionals of presupposition – cannot be expanded because the relevant modus ponens inference would not be cogent. The inference would be question-begging.

The distinction that Davies and Wright argue for also applies to closure principles for justified belief. If they are correct, then justified belief could be closed under known entailment even if justification is not necessarily transmitted across known entailment. The counterexamples to the transmission principle for knowledge would also function as counterexamples for the transmissibility of justified belief.

Some have argued that the Davies-Wright line of argument fails to solve the McKinsey paradox. Whether they are right is beyond the scope of this entry. But the distinction Davies and Wright have drawn between transmission and closure is an important one. That if one knows that p and has validly deduced q from p, one must know that q, tells us nothing about one’s basis for q. Although quite often it can and will, in some instances knowledge of p cannot provide the basis for knowledge of q, even though p entails q, because the justification for p presupposes q. One knows that q (on some independent basis), so there is no counterexample to closure, but q will not be known on the basis of p, so the transmission principle is false.

Clarifying the closure principle as a principle about the distribution of knowledge across known entailment, rather than as a principle about the transmission or acquisition of knowledge, divorces the closure principle, to some extent, from the initial intuitive support for it, which is the idea that we can add to our store of knowledge (or justified belief) by accepting what we know to be entailed by propositions we know (or justifiably believe). On this understanding of closure, knowledge and justified belief are distributed across known entailment even when drawing the inference in question could not add to one’s store of knowledge or justified belief.

6. Ordinary Propositions, Lottery Propositions, and Closure

The closure principle also figures in a paradox about our knowledge of “ordinary propositions” and “lottery propositions.” Ordinary propositions are those that we ordinarily suppose ourselves to know. Lottery propositions are those with a high likelihood of being true, but which we are ordinarily disinclined to say that we know. Suppose that one lives on a fixed income and struggles to make ends meet. It seems that one knows one will not be able to afford a mansion on the French Riviera this year. One’s not being able to afford the mansion this year entails that one will not win the big lottery this year. By the closure principle, since one knows that one will not be able to afford the mansion and one knows that one’s not being able to afford the mansion entails that one will not win the lottery, one must know that one will not win the lottery. Most, however, are disinclined to say that one could know that one will not win the lottery. There’s always a chance, after all (provided that one buys a ticket).

This phenomenon is widespread. Ordinarily, one who keeps up with politics could be said to know that Dick Cheney is the U.S. Vice-President. That Cheney is the Vice-President entails that Cheney did not die of a heart attack thirty seconds ago. But it seems that one does not know that Cheney did not die of a heart attack in the last thirty seconds. How could one know such a thing? (The coining of the term “lottery proposition” and the discovery that this phenomenon is widespread, is due to Jonathan Vogel).

The apparently inconsistent triad is (i) one knows the ordinary proposition, (ii) one fails to know the lottery proposition, and (iii) closure. One may eliminate the inconsistency by denying closure on the sort of grounds that Dretske and Nozick cite. Plausibly, one’s belief of so-called ordinary propositions tracks the truth, while one’s belief of lottery propositions does not. If Cheney were not Vice-President, one would not believe he was, but had Cheney died in the past thirty seconds, one still would believe he was Vice-President.

One might bite the skeptical bullet and insist that one really does not know that Cheney is Vice-President. One of a more anti-skeptical bent might maintain that one can really know the lottery propositions, such as that Cheney did not die in the last thirty seconds. Such a resolution has considerable costs, but denying closure is not among them.

Alternatively, one might argue for a contextualist handling of the problem that does not require the denial of closure or biting the skeptical or anti-skeptical bullet.

7. References and Further Reading

a. References

Audi, Robert (1988), Belief, Justification and Knowledge, Belmont: Wadsworth.
- Argues against closure to avoid dogmatic conclusion.
Audi, Robert (1991), “Justification, Deductive Closure and Reasons to Believe,” Dialogue, 30: 77-84.
- Argues against closure to avoid dogmatic conclusion.
Brueckner, Anthony (1992), “What an Anti-Individualist Knows A Priori,” Analysis 52: 111-118.
- Solution to the McKinsey paradox that does not deny closure.
Brueckner, Anthony (2004), “Strategies for Refuting Closure,” Analysis 64: 333-35.
- Reply to Warfield 2004 and Hales 1995.
Brueckner, Anthony; Fiocco, M. Oreste (2002), “Williamson’s Anti-Luminosity Argument,” Philosophical Studies, 110: 285-293.
- Contains putative counterexample to Dretskean account of knowledge.
Burge, Tyler (1979), “Individualism and the Mental,” Midwest Studies in Philosophy, 4: 73-122.
- Seminal defense of content externalism (or anti-individualism).
Burge, Tyler (1988), “Individualism and Self-Knowledge,” The Journal of Philosophy, 85: 649-663.
- Influential reconciliation of content externalism and the privileged access theses.
Davies, Martin (1998), “Externalism, Architecturalism, and Epistemic Warrant,” in C. MacDonald, B. Smith and C. J. G. Wright (eds.), 321-361.
- Argues that McKinsey paradox is a counterexample to transmission, not closure.
Dretske, Fred (1970), “Epistemic Operators,” The Journal of Philosophy, 67: 1007-1023.
- Seminal paper arguing against the closure of knowledge.
Dretske, Fred (1971), “Conclusive Reasons,” Australasian Journal of Philosophy, 49: 1-22.
- Contains Dretske’s account of knowledge.
Dretske, Fred (2005a), “The Case against Closure,” in Steup and Sosa (eds.), 13-26.
- Argues that denying closure is only way to avoid skepticism.
Dretske, Fred (2005b), “Reply to Hawthorne,” in Steup and Sosa (eds.), 43-46.
- Reply to Hawthorne 2005.
Feldman, Richard (1995), “In Defence of Closure,” The Philosophical Quarterly, 45: 487-494.
- Defends closure against Audi’s arguments (Audi 1988, 1991).
Grice, Paul (1989), Studies in the Ways of Words, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
- Classic treatment of pragmatic/semantic distinction, and conversational maxims and implicatures. Relevant to discussion of the tracking theory of knowledge’s “abominable conjunctions.”
Gunderson, Keith (ed.) (1975), Language, Mind and Knowledge, Minnesota Studies in the Philosophy of Science, volume VII, Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press.
- Contains seminal Putnam 1975 article.
Hales, Steven (1995), “Epistemic Closure Principles,” The Southern Journal of Philosophy 33: 185-201.
- Produces counterexamples to many different formulations of the closure principle, but points out that one cannot refute closure for knowledge by showing that some necessary condition for knowledge fails to be closed.
Harman, Gilbert (1973), Thought, Princeton: Princeton University Press.
- Employs closure principle in formulating dogmatic argument.
Hawthorne, John (2004), Knowledge and Lotteries, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
- Argues for quasi-contextualist solution to problem of lottery propositions, and defends closure.
Hawthorne, John (2005), “The Case for Closure,” in Steup and Sosa (eds.), 26-43.
- Defends closure against Dretske’s 2005a arguments.
Heil, John (1988), “Privileged Access,” Mind 97: 238-251.
- Influential reconciliation of content externalism and privileged access theses.
MacDonald, Cynthia; Smith, Barry; Wright, Crispin (1998), Knowing Our Own Minds: Essays on Self-Knowledge, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- Contains the Davies 1998 article.
McKinsey, Michael (1991), “Anti-Individualism and Privileged Access,” Analysis 51: 9-16.
- Formulation of the McKinsey paradox.
Moore, G.E. (1959), Philosophical Papers, London: George Allen and Unwin, Ltd.
- Contains seminal anti-skeptical essays, such as “Proof of an External World,” and “A Defence of Common Sense.”
Nozick, Robert (1981), Philosophical Explanations, Cambridge: Harvard University Press.
- Influential tracking account of knowledge and consequent denial of closure.
Putnam, Hilary (1975), “The Meaning of ‘Meaning’,” in K. Gunderson (ed.), 131-193.
- Seminal work defending content externalism.
Roth, Michael (ed.) (1990), Doubting: Contemporary Perspectives on Skepticism, Dordrecht: Kluwer.
- Contains Vogel 1990.
Sorensen, Roy (1988), “Dogmatism, Junk Knowledge and Conditionals,” The Philosophical Quarterly, 38: 433-454.
- Solves dogmatism puzzle without denying closure.
Steup, Matthias, and Sosa, Ernest, (eds.) (2005), Contemporary Debates in Epistemology, Malden MA: Blackwell Publishing.
- Contains Dretske-Hawthorne exchange on closure.
Thalberg, Irving (1974), “Is Justification Transmissible Through Deduction?” Philosophical Studies 25: 347-356.
- Argues for counterexample to closure in dogmatism examples.
Unger, Peter (1975), Ignorance: A Case for Scepticism, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- Retains closure but offers skeptical resolution of the dogmatism puzzle.
Veber, Michael (2004), “What do you do with Misleading Evidence?” The Philosophical Quarterly 54: 557-569.
- Reply to Sorensen (1988) and alternative solution to dogmatism puzzle.
Vogel, Jonathan (1990), “Are There Counterexamples to the Closure Principle?” in M. Roth (ed.).
- Influential discussion of closure and lottery propositions.
Wright, Crispin (2000), “Cogency and Question-Begging: Some reflections of McKinsey’s Paradox and Putnam’s Proof,” Philosophical Issues 10: 140-163.
- On the distinction between closure and transmission, and McKinsey’s paradox.

b. Further Reading

Brueckner, Anthony (1985), “Transmission for Knowledge not Established,” The Philosophical Quarterly 35: 193-95.
- Reply to Forbes 1984.
Brueckner, Anthony (2000), “Klein on Closure and Skepticism,” Philosophical Studies 98: 139-151.
- Reply to Klein 1995.
DeRose, Keith (1995), “Solving the Skeptical Problem,” Philosophical Review 104: 1-52.
- Influential defense of contextualist epistemology.
Forbes, Graeme (1984), “Nozick on Scepticism,” The Philosophical Quarterly 34: 43-52.
- Argues that Nozick’s denial of closure cannot adequately handle cases of inferential knowledge.
Goldman, Alvin (1976), “Discrimination and Perceptual Knowledge,” Journal of Philosophy 73: 771-791.
- Defends reliabilist account of knowledge that denies closure, and contains a helpful discussion of the notion of a relevant alternative.
Klein, Peter (1981), Certainty: A Refutation of Skepticism, Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press.
- Argues that defense of knowledge closure assumes internalism about justification, so the skeptic who uses the principle begs the question against the externalist anti-skeptic.
Klein, Peter (1995), “Skepticism and Closure: Why the Evil Genius Argument Fails,” Philosophical Topics 23: 213-236.
- Offers a defense of closure for justification, which, whether the defense succeeds or fails, he says refutes the skeptic.
Luper (-Foy), Steven, (1987), “The Causal Indicator Analysis of Knowledge,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 47: 563-587.
- Argues for a tracking account of knowledge that retains closure.
Pritchard, Duncan (2002), “McKinsey Paradoxes, Radical Scepticism, and the Transmission of Knowledge Across Known Entailments,” Synthese 130: 279-302.
- Reply to Martin and Davies on Transmission and McKinsey paradox.
Salmon, Nathan (1989), “Illogical Belief,” Philosophical Perspectives 3: 243-285.
- Argues that his Millian account of names and belief produces counterexamples to closure principles of justification and knowledge.
Silins, Nicholas (2005), “Transmission Failure Failure,” Philosophical Studies 126: 71-102.
- Argues against the Davies-Wright line on transmission failure.
Sosa, Ernest (1999), “How to Defeat Opposition to Moore,” Philosophical Perspectives 13: 141-152.
- Adjustment of the tracking account of knowledge that allows it to sustain closure.
Stine, Gail (1971), “Dretske on Knowing the Logical Consequences,” Journal of Philosophy 68: 296-299.
- Reply to Dretske 1970.
Warfield, Ted (2004), “When Epistemic Closure Does and Does not Fail: a Lesson from the History of Epistemology,” Analysis 64: 35-41.
- Points out that one cannot refute closure for knowledge by showing that some necessary condition for knowledge fails to be closed.

Author Information

John M. Collins
Email: collinsjo@ecu.edu
East Carolina University
U. S. A.

Open Theism

Open Theism is the thesis that, because God loves us and desires that we freely choose to reciprocate His love, He has made His knowledge of, and plans for, the future conditional upon our actions. Though omniscient, God does not know what we will freely do in the future. Though omnipotent, He has chosen to invite us to freely collaborate with Him in governing and developing His creation, thereby also allowing us the freedom to thwart His hopes for us. God desires that each of us freely enter into a loving and dynamic personal relationship with Him, and He has therefore left it open to us to choose for or against His will.

While Open Theists affirm that God knows all the truths that can be known, they claim that there simply are not yet truths about what will occur in the “open,” undetermined future. Alternatively, there are such contingent truths, but these truths cannot be known by anyone, including God.

Even though God is all-powerful, allowing Him to do everything that can be done, He cannot create round squares or make 2 +2 = 5 or do anything that is logically impossible. Omniscience is understood in a similar manner. God is all-knowing and can know all that can be known, but He cannot know the contingent future, since that too, is impossible. God knows all the possible ways the world might go at any point in time, but He does not know the one way the world will go, so long as some part of what will happen in the future is contingent. So, Open Theists oppose the claim of the sixteenth century Jesuit theologian, Luis de Molina, that God has “middle knowledge.”

Open Theists believe that Scripture teaches that God wanted to give us the freedom to choose to love or reject Him. In order for each of us to genuinely have a choice for which we are morally responsible, we must have the ability to do otherwise than we do. This is the distinctive necessary condition of what has come to be called libertarian freedom. God may intervene in the created world at any time, and He may determine that we act in ways of His choosing. But He cannot both respect our libertarian freedom and guarantee that we will do specific things freely. Thus, Open Theists believe that God has created a world in which He takes the risk that many of us will reject Him and act in ways opposed to Him, in order to give us the opportunity to freely choose to love and obey Him.

History of Open Theism
The Biblical Witness
Philosophical Considerations
Theological Implications
References and Further Reading

1. History of Open Theism

Open Theism has been a significant topic in philosophy of religion and in evangelical Christian circles since the 1994 publication of The Openness of God: A Biblical Challenge to the Traditional Understanding of God by Clark Pinnock, Richard Rice, John Sanders, William Hasker, and David Basinger. Philosophers of religion such as A. N. Prior, J. R. Lucas, Peter Geach, Richard Swinburne, and Richard Purtill had advocated Open Theism in their writings prior to this date, though not under that name, and Rice had published a work initially entitled The Openness of God in 1980. (It was later republished as God’s Foreknowledge and Man’s Free Will.) But the 1994 book’s attempt to systematically explicate the relational view of God that its authors labeled the open view clearly marks the beginning of increased discussion and debate over Open Theism’s tenets.

Since the publication of The Openness of God, there has been significant debate about not only the philosophical and theological merits of Open Theism, but also its orthodoxy. In 2003, The Evangelical Theological Society considered whether to remove Clark Pinnock and John Sanders from its membership for implicitly disavowing the inerrancy of Scripture in their writings by suggesting that some Biblical passages traditionally understood to be prophecies have remained and may continue to remain unfulfilled. While Pinnock agreed to revise the most objectionable passage in his book Most Moved Mover, Sanders continued to maintain that God does not infallibly predict or prophesy what will contingently occur in the future, and he maintained that Biblical passages may initially appear to predicate divine foreknowledge and/or unconditional prophecies by God of what will contingently occur but these passages must be interpreted differently (more below). The charges against Pinnock and Sanders were not sustained, but this was just barely the case for Sanders.

Proponents of Open Theism allow that their view is at odds with the great majority of the Christian tradition in rejecting both meticulous providence and divine foreknowledge of what will contingently occur. However, they argue that the tradition, guided by neo-Platonic philosophy in its formation, had difficulty reconciling beliefs about the implications of God’s perfection with the Biblical witness to a God that cares deeply about His people and how they respond to Him. Many of the early Church Fathers affirmed elements of the Open Theists’ relational view of God, in tension with their beliefs in divine impossibility. Then Saint Augustine, whose Confessions tell us that his faith partially resulted from a careful study of neo-Platonism, forcefully argued for an emphasis on God’s perfection and otherness from His creation that precluded genuine responsiveness on God’s part to our actions. The (Western) Christian tradition subsequently became largely identified with an Augustinian understanding of providence. The early Church Fathers’ idea that God’s foreknowledge is conditioned by human actions did not receive significant consideration again until Jacob Arminius in the sixteenth century and John Wesley in the eighteenth. And it is only recently, in light of philosophical considerations of the nature of freedom, that the full reciprocal relationality of Open Theism has been affirmed, with its concordant denial that God knows what will contingently occur.

Open Theists suggest that when the testimony of Scripture is considered together with philosophical reflection on the conditions necessary for free and morally responsible action, the view that results is theirs. An emphasis on God’s conditioned relationship to His creation is clearly present in the early Church, in the Eastern Church, and in developments during and in response to the Protestant Reformation. This emphasis is largely absent from the theology of the Middle Ages, but the giants of theology from Augustine to Aquinas were clearly attempting to understand God and His relationship to the world in light of the best secular philosophy available to them. While Open Theists acknowledge that their view is in important respects at odds with the Christian tradition, they also maintain that their view is not as dissonant from that tradition as might be thought; it is just that the emphasis on God as a perfect being who does not change in any respect, which is neither clearly taught by Scripture nor obviously compatible with God’s loving relationality, must be rethought.

2. The Biblical Witness

Open Theists suggest that there is a strong Biblical case to be made for affirming a God who respects our moral responsibility while inviting us into a loving relationship with Him. They argue that the most plausible reading of the Bible reveals a personal God who genuinely interacts with human persons and accepts that His desires and projects are dependent on that interaction. As discussed below, Open Theists read the Bible as showing that God desires to be in relationship with the people He has created, that He sometimes changes His mind as a result of dialogue with His people, and that He seeks to accomplish His goals for the world in concert with human agents. They also point to passages that attribute to God the learning of information as evidence that God’s knowledge is not settled, and does not include foreknowledge of the occurrence of contingent events.

Critics of Open Theism offer alternative interpretations of the passages frequently cited by Open Theists, and bring forward their own proof texts that the Biblical God is one whose sovereignty over creation includes exhaustive foreknowledge and ultimate control over each and every aspect of His creation. In any consideration of how well Open Theism accords with the teachings of Scripture, it is important to note that one’s philosophical understandings of freedom and moral responsibility necessarily inform one’s hermeneutic. One cannot fully appreciate the Biblical cases made for or against Open Theism without also appreciating the philosophical considerations to be considered in the subsequent section. Open Theism is most plausible if the dignity and responsibility of an agent require the freedom to do otherwise; if this is so, then texts that attribute responsibility to persons seem to clearly require that God does not also determine the humans’ actions. If foreknowledge is also incompatible with the ability to do otherwise, then neither can God know what we will do. But if our responsibility is consistent with either or both of divine foreknowledge and God’s sovereign determination, then the force of these passages is not nearly as great, and there is no need to seek a more nuanced reading of passages that on their face seem to attribute to God unconditioned knowledge of contingent events in the future.

Open Theists argue that the God revealed in the Bible clearly desires to be in relationship with the people He has created. From the beginning, we have been created in God’s image and given responsibility to care for His creation (Gen. 1:26). God’s relationship to His creation is clear throughout the narrative of the Old Testament. Both Abraham and Moses, among others, speak, and indeed argue, directly with God. Abraham questions God about how His promises will be fulfilled (Gen. 15), and prevails upon Him to spare Sodom if only ten righteous people can be found living there (Gen. 18). Immediately after Abraham shows himself faithful to God by his willingness to obey God even to the point of sacrificing his son Isaac, God states that it is because of Abraham’s obedience that He will maintain His promise to bless Abraham and his descendants (Gen. 22:15-18). Abraham questions God, dialogues with God, affects God’s decisions, and his actions of obedience are credited by God as at least partly responsible for Him fulfilling the promise of blessings that He has revealed to Abraham. Moses speaks with God, and because He lacks confidence to speak to his fellow Israelites, God appoints Aaron to speak for Him (Ex. 4: 1-18). God reveals His law to Moses, and when the Israelites turn their backs on their Deliverer, Moses reminds God of His promises and asks Him to relent from His anger and spare His people (Ex. 32: 9-14). It is clear throughout the Pentateuch that God speaks to chosen leaders of His chosen people, and that He not only commands them, but also listens to their concerns, often adjusting His original plans in light of His dialogue with them.

In both the Old and New Testaments, God presents Himself as working with human agents, and as being disappointed in His hopes for them, rather than as compelling them to act in prescribed ways. This is clear throughout the narrative of Israel, and in passages such as Is. 65:1-2, in which the Lord bemoans the stubbornness of those who will not call on Him, despite His many revelations to them. The Bible teaches us that we can thwart God’s desire that we freely return His love. This is suggested by passages such as Mark 6:5-6, in which we are told that Jesus could not perform many miracles in his hometown because of the lack of faith of its people, and it is explicit in Luke 7:30, in which we are told that the Pharisees rejected God’s purpose. God asks us to follow and obey Him; He does not compel obedience. Nor should every calamitous event be assumed to be divine punishment for disobedience (Job, Lk. 13:1-5, Jn. 9:1-3).

The above passages suggest that God desires to be in relationship with His created people in a manner that respects their freedom to respond to Him in various ways, and that He is genuinely responsive to our concerns. There are also passages in Scripture that more directly suggest that the future is open, and that not even God has foreknowledge of what will contingently happen. Genesis 22:12 records God as stating, “Now I know that you fear God, because you have not withheld from me your son, your only son.” The emphasis on “now” knowing “because” of Abraham’s action clearly points to this being a genuine test of Abraham’s faith, where even God could not be sure of Abraham’s response to the test. Jeremiah 3:7 and 19-20 quote God as saying that He thought Israel would return to faith in Him, but that she had not. Mark 6:6 emphasizes Jesus’ amazement at the lack of faith of those in His hometown, a reaction that only makes sense if He had had an expectation of greater faith. These passages suggest that God can genuinely learn new information.

Of course, the above is meant only to be suggestive of the kinds of considerations that Open Theists emphasize in reading the Bible. These several texts are among those that suggest that God desires to be in a relationship that respects our freedom to respond to God in a variety of ways, and that He has thus left the future open to determination through our actions, at least in part. But critics of Open Theism interpret the same data differently. For instance, Classical Theists may suggest that an incarnational theology’s emphasis on the revelation of God in Christ is misguided if it does not give sufficient weight to the idea that God veiled His glory in becoming human (see Jn. 17:5). And they cite other texts that are arguably more suggestive of the traditional view of God as providentially in control of all that happens, such as Isaiah 40-48, Romans 9, and Ephesians 1:11.

Any reading of the Bible must seek a consistent hermeneutic, and must acknowledge that certain texts must be given readings that are not initially obvious. “Prophetic” texts are read by Open Theists as either decrees of what God has decided to do, conditional predictions about what will happen if certain conditions (such as repentance) are not met, or forecasts based upon God’s exhaustive knowledge of the past and present. None of these interpretations require God to have exhaustive foreknowledge of future events, but responsible readers of the Bible may well disagree about the plausibility of these interpretations as applied to specific passages. Open Theists also argue that plausible readings that accord with Open Theism can be given of “pancausality” texts such as those alluded to in the previous paragraph, and that this is preferable to dismissing as merely anthropomorphic the overwhelming sense of the Bible that God is in dynamic relationship with His creation.

3. Philosophical Considerations

Many theologians in the Christian tradition have maintained both that we are free to choose how we act, and that God foresees our choices. Many lay Christians likewise think that this is the obvious way to reconcile our freedom with God’s omniscience. So long as God does not pre-determine that we act in the ways that we do, but only “sees” what we do, what is the problem? Why does Open Theism insist that the future is open in such a way that God’s foreknowledge of contingent events must be denied?

There are two primary ways of understanding the nature of human freedom. The “compatibilist” view of freedom is that so long as one is acting in a manner that accords with one’s desires or can be otherwise identified with one’s character, one acts freely. Our freedom is compatible with our actions being determined, so long as we are acting in the way we want. We are free so long as were we to desire otherwise, we could act otherwise, and this is so even if we could not desire otherwise. If this is the right view of our freedom, then God might predetermine all of our actions while they are yet free, so long as they are consistent with our character.

The alternative account of the nature of freedom is “libertarian.” This account maintains that unless one is genuinely able to do otherwise than one does, one is not free. So, if one’s character is formed in such a way that one will certainly act in a particular way, and if one has no control over one’s character, then one is not really free, since one cannot act in a manner otherwise than one does. Importantly, one may remain morally responsible for one’s action if one’s character has become thus through one’s earlier free decisions. (Alternatively, one might be said to be free in a derivative sense if one’s character was freely chosen in the past.) If as a result of our sinful nature we cannot choose to do good, then we are not genuinely free to do otherwise than sin. We must really be able to either accept God’s invitation to love Him or to reject it, if we are free with respect to this choice. And if we are not and have never been libertarianly free with respect to this choice , then we are not morally responsible for our choice of whether or not to love God.

Open Theists affirm a libertarian view of freedom. From almost the beginning of Western philosophy, philosophers have been concerned with whether such freedom is compatible with prior truths about what one will do. Aristotle famously argued in his De Interpretatione (book 9) that prior truth is incompatible with future contingency. His argument there may be represented as follows:

It is true that it will be white.
If it is true that it will be white, then it has always been true that it will be white.
If it has always been true that it will be white, then it is impossible that it will not be white.
If it is impossible that it will not be white, then it is necessary that it will be white.
It is necessary that it will be white.

An obvious implication of this argument is that if it is now true that one will act in a particular way, then it is necessary that one will act thusly. But it is not immediately clear why one should accept premise 3. Why should one think that something’s always having been the case entails the impossibility of its ever being otherwise?

One plausible reason for thinking this is based on the idea that one cannot change the past. If a proposition was once true, can one now act in such a way that it is no longer true? If not, then the prior truth of a proposition about what one will do seems enough to rule out one’s doing otherwise, and thus rule out one’s being libertarianly free with respect to that action. The same type of consideration applies to God’s prior knowledge of what one will do. Consider the following argument given by William Hasker in The Openness of God:

It is now true that Clarence will have a cheese omelet for breakfast tomorrow. (Premise)
It is impossible that God should at any time believe what is false, or fail to believe anything that is true. (Premise: divine omniscience)
God has always believed that Clarence will have a cheese omelet tomorrow. (From 1, 2)
If God has always believed a certain thing, it is not in anyone’s power to bring it about that God has not always believed that thing. (Premise: the unalterability of the past)
Therefore, it is not in Clarence’s power to bring it about that God has not always believed that he would have a cheese omelet for breakfast. (From 3, 4)
It is not possible for it to be true both that God has always believed that Clarence would have a cheese omelet for breakfast, and that he does not in fact have one. (from 2)
Therefore, it is not in Clarence’s power to refrain from having a cheese omelet for breakfast tomorrow. (From 5, 6) So Clarence’s eating the omelet tomorrow is not an act of free choice. (From the definition of free will.)

If premise 4 is true and if we have libertarian freedom, then it is not possible for God to know what we will freely do before we do it.

Whether one finds Open Theism plausible largely depends on whether one finds the intuition underlying premise 4 plausible. Philosophers have debated whether all of the past is comprised of “hard” facts fixed in this way, or whether there are “soft” facts that might be conditional upon our future actions. Proponents of the compatibility of human libertarian freedom with divine foreknowledge have argued that facts about God’s prior knowledge of our future actions are conditional on our subsequent choices. To use Clarence as an example, were he to choose to have a bagel tomorrow, it always would have been true that God knew that he would so choose, rather than that he would choose to eat an omelet. Since there is no reason to think that Clarence’s choice is determined by prior causes, divine or otherwise, one may affirm that he is free to have an omelet or not even while maintaining that God knows he will have an omelet. Clarence has what has been termed “counterfactual power” over the past: the power to act in such a way that were he to so act, the past always would have been different than it in fact is. Proponents of counterfactual power over the past can thus agree that Clarence does not have the power to change, or alter, the past, since were he to eat a bagel, it never would have been true that he would eat an omelet tomorrow.

Philosophers have not come to an agreement over whether one might have counterfactual power over the past, or whether the past is instead fixed in a manner that rules out this power. On this topic, basic intuitions about freedom and the fixity of the past differ from person to person, and largely determine how they view the compatibility of divine foreknowledge with human freedom, and thus how they view the plausibility of Open Theism.

It is important to note that even if foreknowledge and freedom are compatible, it is not clear that simple foreknowledge — foreknowledge that is not based on middle knowledge (see below) — could be of any aid to God in providentially ordering His creation. If God knows what will actually happen, He cannot also use this information to arrange for something else to happen, for then the contents of what He “knows” would not comprise knowledge. Foreknowledge is of the actual occurrence of future events; once the occurrence of these events is known, it is “too late” to prevent them (or to bring them about). Doing so is incompatible with their occurrence being infallibly known by God. Simple foreknowledge, if God has it, allows Him to know what will occur without having to wait for the future occurrence of events, as He must for contingent events according to Open Theism. But His knowledge is no less conditioned by the occurrence of the events; He has no greater control over their occurrence based on foreknowledge than He does if Open Theism is true.

Once it is realized that simple foreknowledge does not offer any providential advantage to God, one may wonder what reason there is to affirm it, aside from an assumption that it is more perfect for God to have such knowledge than not. One might think that foreknowledge would provide an explanation for the accuracy of prophecy. But it does not. If God has “at once” complete foreknowledge of all that happens, He “sees” what will happen including whether or not He instructs persons to prophesy that events will happen. Given knowledge of what will occur, God is not free to do otherwise than He foresees He will do. Perhaps God could “look” at a little bit of the future at a time, make decisions about how He will react to the events He foresees, and then “look” a little further to see how His creation reacts to these actions. But this would offer no greater help for predicting future events. Suppose that God foresees the course of the world until the end of 1935. Could He then decide to warn persons on January 1st of 1936 that the holocaust is about to occur? Not in any infallible way. For assuming that the holocaust was still avoidable in 1935, and assuming that God has not yet “looked” beyond 1935, He does not yet know what will occur in the next ten years. He can decide to make probably accurate but possibly mistaken predictions on January 1, 1936, based on the tendencies present at that point, but this is no more than He can do given Open Theism.

Simple foreknowledge has no utility for God’s providential governance of the world, nor can it ground infallible predictions of future events. (It should also be reiterated that Open Theists believe that there are less instances of such predictions in the Bible than is thought by those who affirm a traditional meticulous view of providence.) If one wants to affirm that we have libertarian freedom and still maintain a traditional view of providence according to which God directs the course of the world rather than merely witnessing how it unfolds, then affirming foreknowledge is not enough.

The most plausible view of how human libertarian freedom might be compatible with a traditional view of providence, and thus the greatest competitor to Open Theism, is a view called “Molinism,” named after a sixteenth century Jesuit theologian, Luis de Molina. Molina predicated “middle knowledge” to God and explained God’s providential determination of what will occur in terms of this knowledge. Middle knowledge is knowledge that lies between (in an explanatory sense, not a temporal sense) God’s “natural” knowledge of all the possible ways the world might go and His “free” knowledge of the one way the world will go based upon His creative decree. Natural knowledge is pre-volitional knowledge of necessary truths, including all the possibilities for creation. Free knowledge is post-volitional knowledge of contingent truths, including all future contingent truths. And middle knowledge is pre-volitional knowledge of contingent subjunctive conditional truths of the form: if such and such were the case, then so and so would be the case. God’s middle knowledge includes all the facts about how the world would go given various antecedent conditions. These facts, because they are known before God wills anything, are outside of His control.

Through middle knowledge, God might have known that were he to place Adam and Eve in the Garden of Eden in just the way He did, then they would sin by eating of the tree of the knowledge of good and evil. And He might have known that if they did this and He subsequently kicked them out of the garden, events would unfold in a certain way. God’s middle knowledge would include all the true subjunctive conditionals about how the persons He might create would act in the various circumstances He might place them. These subjunctive conditionals have come to be called “counterfactuals of creaturely freedom.” Based on this exhaustive middle knowledge, God would have known how events would unfold given any creative action He might decide to perform. And on the assumption that libertarian freedom is consistent with knowledge of how one would act in various circumstances, our freedom would remain intact. Molinism promises to uphold both our libertarian freedom and God’s ability to providentially decide exactly what occurs in His creation.

There are two primary objections to Molinism that Open Theists have advanced. If the argument that foreknowledge is incompatible with libertarian freedom is valid, then a similar argument can be made against the compatibility of middle knowledge with libertarian freedom. If it has always been true and known by God that I would act in such and such a way if I were in such and such circumstances, then do I have the power to bring it about that this fact has never been true, or never been known by God? Do I have counterfactual power over this past truth and God’s past knowledge of it? I must, in order to be libertarianly free. The same intuitions about the fixity of the past are brought into play. The other objection to Molinism given by Open Theists, termed the “grounding objection,” is based on the status of the counterfactuals of creaturely freedom. These are truths that, though contingent, are not under God’s control. God “finds Himself” faced with these truths, similarly to the manner in which He “finds Himself” faced with the fact that 2+2=4. But why are certain subjunctives true and certain ones not? The grounding objection is that there seems to be no reason that some particular counterfactuals of creaturely freedom are true rather than others. There is no ground for their truth or falsity. If one believes that all truths, or all contingent truths, must have some underlying ground or “truth-maker,” then one will reject the idea that there are counterfactuals of creaturely freedom available to God prior to creation.

The most important philosophical argument for Open Theism is based on the idea that God’s foreknowledge of one’s actions is incompatible with those actions being free because one does not have the power to bring it about that God has never known something that He does in fact know. But it is important to note that foreknowledge alone is of no help to God in providentially directing the course of His creation. The real competitor to Open Theism as an account of God’s providence is Molinism. Open Theists object to Molinism because they view as implausible the counterfactual power over the past that Molinism requires, and because they believe that there are insufficient grounds for the contingent truth of the counterfactuals of creaturely freedom that Molinists believe God knows via His middle knowledge.

4. Theological Implications

In considering any theology, it is important not only to evaluate the Scriptural and philosophical arguments for and against the view, but also to consider how it might be incorporated into one’s lived faith. So, this article ends with a consideration of the practical implications of Open Theism – for how one views evil, for prayer, and for how one understands the responsibility for salvation.

The traditional view of divine providence holds that each and every event occurs according to God’s will. The implication that the most horrendous evils are thus intended by God has troubled many persons. One of the advantages of Open Theism (and any other view that denies meticulous providence) is that the responsibility for evil is much more clearly removed from God and placed upon our free choices. Because God desires that we freely choose to love Him, he has given us the freedom to reject Him as well, and our acts of rejection take all kinds of horrible forms. The responsibility for the evil that we freely perform is fundamentally ours. While God gave us the ability to do evil things, He does not in any sense intend that we do them. Rather, He grieves with and comforts the victims of our sins.

If God’s will for the world is inviolable, then we must have faith that each instance of evil serves some greater good that God has purposed. On the other hand, if much of the evil in the world is due to our free choices, then there is significant gratuitous evil that serves no further purpose. To those who believe that much of the evil in the world is indeed gratuitous, Open Theism provides an understanding of God’s general project that explains why He allows us to exercise our freedom in ways that sadden Him. He does this because He must do so in order to also allow us the freedom to reciprocate His unfailing love for us.

Not everyone finds this kind of free will defense against the problem of evil comforting. If Open Theism is true, then there is no guarantee that everything will work out as God wants in the end. Open Theists may trust and hope in God’s wisdom and power, but they recognize that there are limitations on what God can effect if we stubbornly refuse to aid Him. Some persons find it easier to have faith in an inscrutable secret will of God that is furthered by the evil we witness. This response to evil also has the advantage of applying to natural evil as well as evil events that result from our actions. While Open Theists may point out that much of the “natural” evil in the world is exacerbated by our poor stewardship of the earth, they must also seek additional explanations for God’s allowance of the devastation and suffering brought about by natural disasters.

Just as one’s views of freedom and of whether the past is fixed in such a way to rule out counterfactual power over it are good predictors of whether one finds Open Theism plausible, one’s reaction to evil is also a reliable indicator of how one thinks of Open Theism. If one cannot imagine that a good and loving God would intend that genocide, torture, rape, and other horrendous evils occur for some inscrutable good, then one is likely to find a free will theodicy, and Open Theism, comforting. If instead one cannot imagine that God would allow us to perform such horrible acts, or allow the massive suffering caused by natural disasters, without there being some very great good that they serve, then one is likely to put one’s faith in the mysterious but certain goodness of God’s meticulous governance of creation.

One of the advantages of Open Theism against any theology that affirms divine foreknowledge or foreordination is that prayer can genuinely influence God’s decisions. Because the future is open and not yet determined, we may pray that God will exercise His influence in ways we desire. We may ask that He will aid ourselves or others. We may easily make sense of James’ assertion that “You do not have, because you do not ask God.” (Ja. 4:2b) In contrast, if God determines the occurrence of each and every event, then He also determines whether and how we pray. On a traditional view of God that affirms His meticulous sovereignty, our prayer is ultimately brought about by God; it cannot persuade God. And even if God merely foreknows our prayers as part of His exhaustive foreknowledge, rather than bringing those prayers about, He also foreknows His response to those prayers, so that there is no greater room for our prayers to influence God’s decisions. Only if the future is open does prayer that God will act in certain ways make sense. Since we often pray in this way, this is an important consideration in favor of Open Theism.

However, proponents of more traditional views of sovereignty can attempt to minimize the purported advantage that Open Theism has for understanding prayer by asking what essential role prayer plays in God’s decision-making, even if Open Theism is true. Since God knows everything about the past and present, and the probabilities of what might occur in the future, can prayer really inform God of anything? He already knows our every thought and desire, and whether our wants are likely to be good for us. Given this, should we think of God as waiting for us to pray to take whatever action seems best for those for whom we pray? Perhaps. It may be that the action of making a request is important – perhaps we do not really understand what it is we would ask, until we bring ourselves to ask it. It also may be that God sometimes grants requests that we make, even though He believes that they are ill-advised, because He believes that we will learn important lessons from pursuing the course of action we desire. Open Theists may respond to the above line of criticism in various ways, but it should be clear that the advantage that Open Theists have for understanding prayer as a means of influencing God is not as great as it initially appears.

The critical questions about how our prayers might influence the actions God chooses to take in the world do not apply in the same way to prayers for divine guidance. Here too, Open Theists have the advantage of a view that allows God to genuinely guide and advise His followers, because the future is not determinate. We may pray that God would guide us in important choices that we must make, trusting in His greater knowledge of the possible and probable effects of these choices. This too is an important kind of prayer that we often exercise, and so the advantage of being able to understand how God might genuinely guide us in response to prayers that He do so is an important benefit of affirming Open Theism. Molinists may say that God chooses to create a world in which He always knows that and how we will pray, in which He knows how He will respond to these prayers, and in which He knows how we will respond to His “guidance.” But assuming that Open Theists are right to deny counterfactual power over the past, God’s responses to prayer given Molinism cannot constitute advice that one may take or not, as it does given Open Theism, precisely because Molinists view the future as determinate and known by God once God has willed His initial creation.

Of course, God’s guidance is limited to His knowledge of how things will probably go if one thing is done rather than another. He cannot know what will happen as a result of our decision so long as the effects of that decision will be influenced by other free decisions. And the further in the future we consider, the less certain that even God can be of what will occur. So while God’s advice about what to do is certainly much better than any other person’s, it is no guarantee that everything will in fact go well. Furthermore, the idea of praying for guidance is most easily understood on a dialogical model, in which we speak with and hear from God. If one does not feel that God usually communicates with us so directly, then it is harder to understand how He might guide us in any precise way. It is important to note that seeking “signs” of God’s will for us is not likely to be particularly reliable if those signs could also be brought about or blocked by other free agents.

In light of the above discussion, we may conclude that Open Theists can understand the efficacy of prayers that God will act in certain ways and prayers for divine guidance in decision-making. In contrast, those who affirm meticulous providence or exhaustive and settled foreknowledge of what will contingently occur plausibly cannot understand this efficacy, since there seems to be no room for our prayers to affect God or for His response to them to affect our decisions, if the decisions of both God and ourselves have always been foreknown, and perhaps foreordained. But we have also seen that what initially seems to be a clear advantage for Open Theism is tempered by questions about how exactly we might influence God, and about how exactly He might communicate His advice to us in response to prayers for guidance.

The final theological implication of Open Theism that requires discussion is the degree to which we have a greater responsibility for our salvation if Open Theism is true. Traditionally, Christians have emphasized that we are constrained by our sinful nature in such a way that we cannot respond favorably to God without additional grace given by Him. If this grace is both necessary and sufficient for a “salvific” faith, then the ultimate cause of whether one is saved or not is God’s giving or withholding of that grace, rather than any “choice” one makes. Open Theism claims that it is essential that the choice for or against God that determines our salvation be genuinely up to us. We must be free to choose to love or reject God, in order for our choice to love Him to be genuine, and giving us that genuine choice is the reason that God has given us libertarian freedom.

To what extent is God’s glory diminished by His giving us a greater role in our salvation, that of genuinely choosing whether or not to follow Him? While some opponents of Open Theism have argued that any attribution to human persons of an ability to determine a necessary condition of salvation impugns God’s sovereignty, it is not at all clear that this is so. If Open Theism is true, we are still dependent on God’s gracious and freely-given invitation to us to love Him and thereby be saved. Open Theists may even affirm a doctrine of sin that predicates to us an inability to respond favorably to God without further enabling grace. But they claim that God has extended this enabling grace to all persons through Jesus Christ and the Holy Spirit. The only thing that we do is decide whether or not to accept the greatest gift imaginable. There is no cause for pride on our part in making the right choice. If we truly appreciate God’s glorious sovereignty, rather than requiring that His sovereignty be understood in particular ways, then the only appropriate response to God’s invitation involves humility.

The debate over whether Open Theism correctly portrays God’s relationship to His creation involves a complicated web of Biblical data, philosophical arguments, and reflection on the practical theological implications of the view. Certain points of contention clearly divide those who might consider Open Theism from those who will not: a belief that libertarian freedom is essential to moral responsibility, a belief that the past is fixed in such a way that we do not have the ability to bring it about that it was always different, and a belief that evil should be attributed to our imperfect human decisions rather than to a secret inscrutable will of God. Of these three beliefs, it is the second that divides Open Theists from Molinists, who also affirm libertarian freedom but attempt to do so in concert with meticulous providence. Even if one affirms all three of these beliefs, however, there remains the hard work of slowly working through a detailed examination of Scripture and reflection on the Christian life. This is the case for any theology, and it is perhaps especially so for a relatively young theology such as Open Theism.

5. References and Further Reading

a. For Open Theism

David Basinger, The Case for Freewill Theism: A Philosophical Assessment (Downer’s Grove, IL: InterVarsity Press, 1996).
- A brief consideration of freewill theism generally, and open theism specifically, especially as applied to the topics of omniscience, evil, and prayer.
Gregory A. Boyd, God of the Possible: A Biblical Introduction to the Open View of God (Grand Rapids, MI: Baker Books, 2000).
- A brief and easy to read consideration of the Biblical case for Open Theism.
Terence Fretheim, The Suffering of God: An Old Testament Perspective, Overtures to Biblical Theology (Philadelphia: Fortress Press, 1984).
- A study of the use of metaphors in describing God in the Old Testament, and a case for predicating suffering, and thus genuine responsiveness, to God.
William Hasker, “Foreknowledge and Necessity,” Faith and Philosophy 2, no. 2 (April 1985), 121-157.
- An extended argument that foreknowledge is incompatible with libertarian freedom.
William Hasker, God, Time and Knowledge, Cornell Studies in the Philosophy of Religion (Ithaca, N.Y.: Cornell University Press, 1998).
- A book length exposition of the philosophical case for Open Theism. Also a good place to start to get a sense of the philosophical debate over the relationship of freedom and divine foreknowledge.
William Hasker, Providence, Evil, and the Openness of God, Routledge Studies in the Philosophy of Religion (New York: Routledge, 2004).
- A consideration of the strengths of Open Theism in comparison with Calvinism, process theism, and Molinism, especially with regard to the problem of evil and the question of divine action within the world.
Clark H. Pinnock, Most Moved Mover: A Theology of God’s Openness (Grand Rapids, MI: Baker Books, 2001).
- An exposition of Open Theism in terms of the controlling metaphor of God as love that treats in turn: the Scriptural foundations for Open Theism, the development of traditional Christianity influenced by Hellenic philosophy, the philosophical case for Open Theism, and Open Theism’s adequacy to the practical demands of living one’s faith.
Clark H. Pinnock, Richard Rice, John Sanders, William Hasker, and David Basinger. The Openness of God: A Biblical Challenge to the Traditional Understanding of God (Downers Grove, Ill.: InterVarsity, 1994).
- The book that began the extensive debate over Open Theism. A series of five essays that consider Biblical and historical considerations in favor of Open Theism, what a systematic openness theology amounts to, the philosophical case for this view, and its practical implications. An appropriate starting point for anyone interested in learning about Open Theism.
Richard Rice, God’s Foreknowledge and Man’s Free Will (Eugene, OR: Wipf and Stock Publishers, 2004). Previously published as The Openness of God: The Relationship of Divine Foreknowledge and Human Free Will (Minneapolis: Bethany House, 1980).
- An early argument for the present-knowledge or open view of God.
John Sanders, The God Who Risks: A Theology of Providence (Downers Grove, Ill.: InterVarsity Press, 1998).
- The best exposition of Open Theism to date, especially with respect to the Biblical case for the view, and in systematically setting out openness theology. Also an excellent source of additional references to texts related to Open Theism.
Richard Swinburne, The Coherence of Theism, rev. ed. (New York: Oxford University Press, 1993).
- A penetrating philosophical case for understanding theism in a manner that accords with Open Theism’s view, made prior to the widespread use of that term.

b. Against Open Theism

William Lane Craig, The Only Wise God: The Compatibility of Divine Foreknowledge and Human Freedom (Eugene, OR: Wipf and Stock Publishers, 2000).
- An argument for the compatibility of divine foreknowledge and human libertarian freedom based on Molinism’s attribution to God of middle knowledge of subjunctive conditionals about what free agents will do in particular circumstances (counterfactuals of creaturely freedom).
Millard Erickson, What does God Know and When does He know it?: The Current Controversy over Divine Foreknowledge (Grand Rapids, MI: Zondervan, 2003).
- An extended argument against Open Theism that also calls for greater moderation and civility in the debate over the topic.
Thomas P. Flint, Divine Providence: The Molinist Account (Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press, 1998).
- The most thorough explication of Molinism, with critiques of both orthodox Thomistic and Open Theistic views of divine providence.
John Frame, No Other God: A Response to Open Theism (Phillipsburg, NJ: Presbyterian & Reformed, 2001).
- A critique of Open Theism based on a Reformed reading of Scripture.
Norman L. Geisler and H. Wayne House, The Battle for God: Responding to the Challenge of Neotheism, (Grand Rapids, MI: Kregal Publications, 2001).
- Calling Open Theism “neotheism,” this work argues that Open Theism is dangerously far from traditional Christianity, and seeks to explicate the orthodox view of God’s attributes.
Paul Helm, The Providence of God. Contours of Christian Theology, (Downers Grove: IL: InterVarsity Press, 1994).
- A systematic explication of God’s providence as risk-free meticulous sovereignty.
Beyond the Bounds: Open Theism and the Undermining of Biblical Christianity, edited by John Piper, Justin Taylor, and Paul Helseth (Wheaton, IL: Crossway Books, 2003).
- A series of essays arguing that Open Theism is unorthodox and not an acceptable form of Christianity.
Still Sovereign: Contemporary Perspectives on Election, Foreknowledge, and Grace, edited by Thomas R. Schreiner and Bruce A. Ware (Grand Rapids, MI: Baker Books, 2000).
- A series of essays explicating and defending the classical view of divine sovereignty.
Bruce A. Ware, God’s Lesser Glory: The Diminished God of Open Theism (Wheaton, Ill: Crossway Books, 2001).
- An argument, primarily based on his reading of Scripture, that Open Theism is false and its consequences are dire.
R. K. McGregor Wright, No Place for Sovereignty: What’s Wrong with Freewill Theism (Downer’s Grove, IL: InterVarsity Press, 1996).
- An attempt to show what’s wrong biblically, theologically, and philosophically with freewill theism, both in its contemporary (Open Theism) and historical forms (Arminianism).

c. Multiple Views

Predestination and Free Will: Four Views of Divine Sovereignty and Human Freedom, edited by David Basinger and Randall Basinger (Downer’s Grove, IL: InterVarsity Press, 1986).
- Essays in favor of foreordination (John Feinberg), foreknowledge (Norman Geisler), God’s self-limited power (Bruce Reichenbach), and God’s self-limited knowledge (Clark Pinnock), with responses by each author to the other essays.
Divine Foreknowledge: Four Views, edited by James Beilby and Paul Eddy (Downer’s Grove, IL: InterVarsity Press, 2001).
- Essays in favor of Open Theism (Gregory Boyd), simple foreknowledge (David Hunt), middle knowledge or Molinism (William Lane Craig), and the Augustinian-Calvinist view (Paul Helm), with responses by each author to the other essays.
God and Time: Four Views, edited by Gregory Ganssle (Downer’s Grove, IL: InterVarsity Press, 2001).
- Essays on divine timeless eternity (Paul Helm), eternity as relative timelessness (Alan Padgett), timelessness and omnitemporality (William Lane Craig), and unqualified divine temporality (Nicholas Wolterstorff), with responses by each author to the other essays.
Christopher Hall and John Sanders, Does God Have a Future?: A Debate on Divine Providence, (Grand Rapids, MI: Baker Books, 2003).
- The product of a year’s dialogue via email between Hall, who affirms a classical theism, and Sanders, an Open Theist, about divine providence and foreknowledge.

Author Information

James Rissler
Email: amf@atlantamennonite.org
Oglethorpe University
U. S. A.

Color

Philosophy has long struggled to understand the nature of color. The central role color plays in our lives, in visual experience, in art, as a metaphor for emotions, has made it an obvious candidate for philosophical reflection. Understanding the nature of color, however, has proved a daunting task, despite the numerous fields that contribute to the project. Even knowing how to start can be difficult. Is color to be understood as an objective part of reality, a property of objects with a status similar to shape and size? Or is color more like pain, to be found only in experience and so somehow subjective? Or is color more like what some have said about time–that it seems real until we reflect enough, where we come ultimately to dismiss it as mere illusion? If color is more like shape and size, can we give a scientific account of it? Various strategies exist for this option–taking the color of an object to be just a complicated texture of that object, one that reflects certain wavelengths. Or perhaps color is merely a disposition to cause experiences in us, as salt has a disposition to dissolve. On the other hand, if color is more like pain, and found only in subjective experience, what is the nature of color experience? How, for instance, does an experience of red differ from an experience of blue, or from an experience of pain for that matter? Finally, if color is mere illusion, how do we continue to be so taken in by that illusion and how can something unreal seem so real and important to us?

There are just some of the questions that have been raised about color, ones we will address in this article. Of course, this is only a beginning, for it is not only the scientist or scientifically-inclined philosopher that wonders about color. Accounts of color have been given by anthropologists, artists, philosophers interested in metaphysics, and many others. How their accounts go, and how they all fit together makes for fascinating philosophy. This article will offer an introduction to philosophical issues of color, with an eye to exploring some of the answers that have been offered to some of the puzzles. As always in philosophy, the discussion has to begin somewhere, though it need not ever end.

Color, Philosophy, and Science
1. Realism
  1. Non-Reductive Realism
  2. Reductive Realism
    1. Physicalism
    2. Dispositionalism
1. Subjectivism
  1. Mentalism
  2. Eliminativism
Color and Metaphysics
1. Color Skepticism
2. Color and Internal Relations
Is Color Experience Universal?
1. Linguistic Determinism
2. Berlin and Kay
References and Further Reading
1. Overviews and General Discussions
2. Specific Positions

1. Color, Philosophy, and Science

Many contemporary debates about color have their origin in the rise of modern science. The emerging scientific picture of the 16th and 17th centuries demoted color, sound, taste and other aesthetically interesting properties to second-class status, according them the pejorative title of “secondary qualities.” Primary qualities, such as shape, size, motion, and number, in contrast, seemed necessary and sufficient to explain the behavior of physical objects and were thereby countenanced by the new physics as the truly real. From the perspective of physics, secondary qualities such as color were deemed explanatorily idle, and thus at best were said to be present in bodies only as complex structures of primary qualities, and so do not resemble our ideas of them. At worst, color and the like were dismissed as mere illusory appearances. Color would no more be in objects than pain is. Either way, the world was seen as not colored–or at least, if there is color in reality, it bears little resemblance to the color we are so intimately aware of.

With this background, contemporary philosophers face a choice of sorts. Should color be assimilated, on the one hand, to shape and size, and thus accountable in a scientific manner, not requiring appeal to sensory experience? Or, on the other hand, are colors more like sensations of pain, and thus personal, subjective features of experience? These questions trigger different responses, and so determine numerous accounts of the nature of color. Early portions of this article will examine the interplay between common sense and science on the nature of color, with an eye to answering those questions.

But philosophical issues of color are not limited to these debates. Color plays such an important role in our lives, in so many different ways, that it is not surprising that other issues should arise. We will explore some of these as well. Like children then, philosophers are fascinated by color. Unlike children, we have sophisticated concepts and tools at our disposal to help us understand the mysteries of color.

To begin let us ask, “Are physical objects, independently of perceivers’ experiences, colored? Again, were we to discard what is found in experience, would it still be correct to say that objects are colored?”

Realism about color, as understood here, maintains that yes, objects are colored. In particular, Realism holds that objects are colored, regardless of whether anyone is looking at an object, regardless if the color is perceived. In so maintaining that objects are colored, we are saying that the essence of color is to be found in the nature of the objects that are colored, as opposed to being within the minds of perceivers. Subjectivism, on the other hand, holds that it is false to say that objects are colored. But even if objects are not colored, surely there are experiences of color. And in this way we can find a place for color, by including the perceivers and perception of color. Subjectivism gets its name because of the role of the subjects of experience, where color is now to be found. In saying that color exists within subjective experiences of color, however, we need not mean there is something arbitrary or illusory about color. Color could be something that really does exist within perceivers, which can be studied, measured, and explained.

As we articulate these positions more precisely, we will discover that there are various ways to claim that objects are colored, just as there are various ways to understand the claim that there are only experiences of color. Due to limitations of space, we can only hope to introduce the reader to some of the positions and complexities of the debate, and hope that is enough to both satisfy one’s initial curiosity and to also spur one to learn more.

a. Realism

Realism holds that objects are colored. So does common sense. Science, particularly physics, apparently threatens that view. For science tells us, in the first place, that ordinary objects–trees, houses, cars, are themselves just complexes of more basic items (atoms, protons, electrons, quarks, and so forth). And in the second place, these scientific objects are not colored. We thus seem on the verge of paradox as we consider the following two claims.

CS: (Ordinary) objects are colored.
CP: Ordinary objects are bundles of basic scientific objects.
PS: Basic scientific objects are not colored.

(Though CP is clearly relevant to this discussion, it will not be explored further.) What then should we say about CS, the claim that common sense objects are colored, given the hard-to-deny threat posed by PS, the claim that the physicist’s entities are not colored? Several strategies emerge.

i. Non-Reductive Realism

Non-Reductive Realism about color holds there to be no distinction between what are called the primary and secondary qualities of objects. Both types exist in the object just as they present themselves. A red ball looks to have primary qualities (the shape, size, mass, and so forth) and secondary qualities (the color, the smell, the warmth, and so forth) and on this view, the object truly does have both kinds of qualities. The color exists “cheek by jowl” with the shape. Using some technical terms, we might say that on this view, shape and color are both irreducible qualities; they are basic and appear as they really are. In contrast, as we will see, other versions of Realism will deny color exists as such a basic quality. Instead, such views will reduce color to something more basic.

The motivation for Non-Reductive Realism, otherwise known as Primitivism, is clear enough, namely to allow us to take seriously our common sense view of the world, in which color plays an obvious and significant role. But as we have said, the scientific view of reality threatens common sense. On many fronts, science tells us to be suspicious of our everyday, common beliefs. When it comes to color, science typically seeks to explain our experiences of color by invoking scientifically respectable properties, the ones that lend themselves to mathematization, namely the primary qualities. In schematic form, we are said to perceive red, for instance, because of the shape and texture of a given object, which in turn reflects certain wavelengths of light to our eyes, which then send electrical impulses to our brain, resulting in the experience of color. More generally, the thought is that we should attribute to physical objects only those properties necessary and sufficient to explain their physical behavior, and that this can be accomplished by reference solely to the so-called primary qualities (hence their status as “primary”.) Since the property of red, for instance, seems to play no causal role in our experience of red, it should not be included in the list of properties that characterize physical objects. What does the explaining instead is the texture of the object, the wavelengths of light that are reflected, and so forth. Worse still, even if objects were colored in the irreducible, or what we could call the occurrent sense, it is not clear how that would help our perception of red objects. For again, the mechanism used to explain the perception of red makes use only of light, surface texture and the like. Color is left as explanatorily idle and should not be said to be part of the physical world. So goes the threat from science, as we have said.

How might the Non-Reductive Realist reply? One strategy denies that CS and PS are truly incompatible. Each might be argued to be true in their own way, and that therefore no problem arises. Why? Because 1) common sense and physics, and thus CS and PS respectively, operate at different levels of analysis and 2) there is no ultimately right level of analysis, and so, 3) we are not forced to choose between them. Consider another area where we do not feel the need to choose one level of analysis over another. For instance, we accept explanations of people’s behavior by describing their beliefs and desires. Even though we suspect that those beliefs and desires could (eventually) be given a description at the level of brain processes, we do not think we must appeal to that level in order to genuinely describe and explain. So too a level of discourse that speaks of objects’ irreducible properties seems autonomous and respectable, even if there is another level according to which there are not such colors. The autonomy of this level then could withstand the encroaching scientific perspective, allowing us to maintain both, if we like.

Of course, someone who takes science’s dictates to be the ultimate word on what does really exist–that science is the measure of all that is, will not be swayed by these considerations. And for those philosophers, they now must face that conflict between common sense and science. But again there is possibility for reconciliation. This, however, requires a reinterpretation of the claim that objects are colored, one that makes use of the notion of reduction.

ii. Reductive Realism

Since the Modern era, scientifically-inclined philosophers have sought a way to reconcile common sense claims with the philosophic-scientific view that color plays no role in physical explanations, should not be countenanced as basic, and thus is not in the objects in a basic sense. Faced with the inadequacies of Non-Reductive Realism, and with the general sentiment that our ontology should be given by science (or at least not be inconsistent with our best scientific theory), we might seek a scientifically respectable account of red and the like.

The hope has been to give a scientific account of these qualities by showing them to be just complicated physical properties, that is, primary qualities. If we can show how color is really just a combination of say, complex, microphysical properties that characterize the surface of objects, ones that cause certain wavelengths to be reflected, we will have given an account of their nature comparable to what has been done with observable shape, size, weight, texture, motion and the like. Objects can be now said to be colored, where that color now is understood as really just a complex of physical, primary, properties. We will have reduced color to properties and relations that do not include occurrent or basic color.

Our original conflict, then between:

CS: Objects are colored
PS: Basic scientific objects are not colored

disappears as CS is reinterpreted to mean that objects are colored in a reduced, non-occurrent sense. Just as scientists have shown sound to be nothing more than wavelengths in a medium, and shown heat to be kinetic energy, a similar reduction has been proposed for color.

1) Physicalism

How exactly does this reduction go? One broad strategy, known as Physicalism, seeks to reduce color to those physical properties (primary qualities) sufficient to explain why we see objects as colored in the basic, self-presenting, occurrent sense. But saying we can give a reductionist account of color that appeals only to the physical properties of objects and light is far from actually doing it. And there are many obstacles to the actual reduction. Here is why, in part: There are many, many different physical causes which, when they impinge upon our highly sensitive visual system, yield the same experienced color. Consider the color blue, and the many places blue appears. It turns out there are drastically different physical causes for the blue of sapphire; the blue of lapis; that of turquoise; from blue dye to blue in the rainbow; the blue of water compared with the sky; the blue on tv, compared with the blue of a bluish star. In short, identity or even similarity in color of objects does not imply similarity in physical structure of object. (Making matters worse, similarity in physical structure does not even imply similar color appearances. The same reflected range of light, but at different angles of reflection, will make for different colors–this is part of the explanation of the phenomenon of iridescence).

For simplicity, let us ignore the differing physical mechanisms that explain the blue of the sky (dispersal of light), the blue of water (reflection), and the blue of a rainbow (refraction). Instead, just focus on the blue of ordinary objects. Can we give a reductive, physicalist account of this blue, one that allows us to say the object is blue, but in a non-basic way? Here is how one version of Physicalism goes. (We have referred to this as “Reductive Physicalism, but as we are noting now, this is but one of various forms of that approach. We might think of the version about to be discussed as Disjunctive Reductive Physicalism.) A given color is defined by reference to the (micro)physical features that characterize the surfaces of objects; features which are then responsible for reflecting particular wavelengths to perceivers’ eyes. What is a color then? It is that complicated set of primary qualities which characterize the surface of an object. Some surfaces are structured to cause experience of red, some to cause blue, and so forth. The color itself, of an object, is that surface structure, which can be accounted for in physical terms–that is, describable by physics, chemistry and the like.

An immediate problem arises, even for this simplified phenomenon. This is the phenomenon known as metamerism, according to which different combinations of wavelengths (in the same conditions) give rise to identical color experiences. The reason metamers make things difficult is that two objects can have very different surface textures–at the microphysical level–and thus can reflect very different wavelengths to perceivers. But these very different wavelengths can be experienced as the exactly same color. For instance, light that is 100% 577 nm (a nanometer is a billionth of a meter) will appear as pure yellow. But light that is composed of 50% 540 nm and 50% 670 nm will appear qualitatively indistinguishable. Since different physical structures can produce different wavelengths, all of which yield the same color experience, it appears we are left defining color as the structure of an object by saying:

Yellow= microstructure1 OR microstructure2 OR microstructure3 OR…

This is, in other words, a disjunction and yellow looks to be definable as a disjunction only. There is apparently no single physical property of objects, of wavelengths, of reflections of light, and so forth. that all yellow objects have in common–let alone yellow of non-ordinary objects like the sun, after-images, and so forth.

With these scientific facts in hand we approach the matter now as philosophers. What should we say about the reduction of a property, in this case, a color, to a disjunction? Consider various problems raised. First, if the list of conditions that characterize yellow (or any color) is infinite, as it might be, then it hardly seems that we have reduced color. Even were it just a long finite list, as seems equally possible, we also might object to the claim that such disjunctive properties are real properties at all. Most troubling, however, is that there does not seem to be a unifying physical condition which explains why these all are instances of yellow. The only thing that explains why these various physical conditions are yellow is that they cause experiences of yellow. Thus our seemingly perceiver-independent account of color actually seems to require reference to perceivers. For without perceivers of color in the picture, we no way to explain why some physical conditions are yellow and some are not. And that leaves us with the disturbing sense that our list of physical conditions is just a hodgepodge, a gerrymandered set of properties, not a genuine explanatorily useful reduction. And while there are other ways to develop such Physicalism, the problems we have outlined have sufficed to send philosophers looking elsewhere for an account.

2) Dispositionalism

Failing to find a single (micro)property that explains an experience of a certain color, while still hoping to reconcile the claim that objects are colored with the scientific claim that color is not basic, philosophers have hit upon another reductive strategy. John Locke is usually credited here as the originator of this Dispositionalism, as he writes,

“Such qualities, which in truth are nothing in the Objects themselves, but Powers to produce various Sensations in us by their primary qualities, that is, by the Bulk, Figure, Texture, and Motion of their insensible parts, as Colours, Sounds, Tastes, and so forth. These I call secondary qualities.” (Locke, An Essay Concerning Human Understanding. Bk.II, Chpt. VIII, §10.)

To appreciate this claim, recall that we are still looking for a reductive account of color, but as well, have rejected Physicalist attempts at reduction. With that in mind, we might step back and notice that the Physicalist account of color was given by focusing largely, if not completely, on the object itself, leaving aside our experience of color–what it is like and how it might play a role in understanding color. Perhaps the absence of even a reference to experience is the source of the trouble. For certainly our motivation to understand color itself comes from reflection on our experience of color–especially as we put that alongside an account of reality that tells us to be suspicious of our common sense experiences of the world. Maybe we will do better by approaching the nature of color with a role for the fact that color is an experienced quality. With this in mind, we might develop an account of color that brings out the extent to which the particular nature of color is linked with experiences of color, though the color itself is still said to be a property of objects.

To develop this account, philosophers draw attention to the following true biconditional:

(C): x is red if and only if x appears red under standard conditions.

Red objects, that is, appear red in standard conditions (to normal perceivers), and if an object appears red to a normal perceiver, in normal conditions, then that object is red. What explains this? Here it is claimed that C is true because of a deeper truth about color, namely, that the color of an object just is the disposition of that object to appear red. Let us call this DC, and let it be the Dispositionalist’s definition of color.

(DC): x is red = x is disposed to appear red (to normal perceivers in standard conditions).

Of course, there are also corresponding biconditionals for shapes of objects. Examination of their different status will make clearer the goal and nature of Dispositionalism. Consider then,

(S): x is square iff x appears square under standard conditions (to normal perceivers)

This too is true, but does not entail a parallel treatment of square’s essence. For we will not accept,

(DS): x is square = x is disposed to appear square (to normal perceivers in standard conditions).

The reason we will not move from S to DS is instructive. For when it comes to such properties as being square, we believe that an account of its nature can be given by simple appeal to an objects’ physical properties, without appeal to how it appears to perceivers. We have no temptation to give a dispositionalist account of square for the essence of square. In contrast, color can be thought of as a property of physical objects, but only in a thin sense, namely, the disposition to cause in us certain experiences. Which experience? The appearance of the very color in question.

The merits of this account are numerous. First, we have found a way to keep our common sense claim, CS from above, though with a reinterpretation of CS. Objects are colored, though not in a basic sense. Second, we now also have room to take seriously the dictates of science according to which the basic entities of reality are not colored. What we can say is that if those basic entities are put together in suitable ways, ordinary objects come to have certain powers or dispositions, namely in this case, to cause experience of colors such as red. This makes for another merit. Objects can said to be red, or blue, and so forth, and we can distinguish veridical from non-veridical perceptions of color. One might experience a truly blue object as green, because either the viewing conditions are not standard (for instance, in certain kinds of light), or because something is amiss with the perceiver. In the second case, the perception was not veridical, for there is a way the object really is colored. This allows, in other words, for intersubjective agreement about the colors of objects, and thus keeps color from being purely subjective or relative. Finally, we can say that objects do have their colors even when not being observed, or even when they are in the dark. For even in the dark, objects do have the disposition to appear certain ways, and of course, that is what we are saying color really is. In this way color is said to be real, as we want when considering the matter from common sense. Yet in another sense, color is relative to a perceiver–for an object only has a disposition to appear red–and the experience of red, for instance, does require a perceiver, and an element of subjectivity. The total package then is a nice blend of objective and subjective elements, and for many is just what we should expect from a good explanation of color.

In sum, these features have made Dispositionalism a tempting and popular position. We now explore some objections to this view, leaving it to the reader to decide for themselves whether or not these objections are compelling.

It is often complained against Dispositionalism, for instance, that colors do not look like dispositions. They look like basic, occurrent properties, just like the shapes of objects. How then, it is questioned, could color really be a disposition, if it does not look like one at all? Here we might expect the Dispositionalist to ask us to specify exactly how we would expect a disposition to look in the first place. The Dispositionalist will then argue that once we actually figure out how we would expect color as disposition to appear, we discover that that is just how colors do appear. For example, if color were a disposition to appear red in standard conditions, then in standard conditions, a red object would look red. And is not that just what it does look like?

Perhaps more troubling, however, is that Dispositionalism seems circular. What is red? A disposition to appear a certain way. Which way? To appear as red, of course. Red, then, is a disposition to appear red. If “red” is being used the same way here, then we have explained “red” by reference to “appears red”. That seems straightforwardly circular, and thus problematic. Interestingly, some philosophers have taken this to be a serious problem, while others have suggested it is a harmless and even expected result. After all, they say, we have wanted an account of color that appeals to our experience of it. Thus the only way to explain what red is is to describe our experiences of red. In this case the circularity is not threatening, but simply an indication that our desired account of color required appeal to the experience of color to make sense of it in the first place. That, again, was what made explanation of red different from explanation of shape. On the other hand, circular accounts do not provide much information, and as such we might still wonder what we have really learned about the nature of red, if that is just a disposition to appear red.

Finally, some have worried that if color is a disposition, we are now incapable of explaining why we have experiences of color at all. Consider this parallel. We can taste the saltiness of a pretzel. Why? Because the pretzel was salty. And the salt has a disposition to dissolve and cause experiences of tasting salty. But it is not the disposition to dissolve that is responsible for the taste of salt. It is the non-dispositional properties of salt that both cause it to dissolve and which cause the taste of salt. Again, it is not salt’s dispositions that cause our experiences of salty taste. It is the non-dispositional properties that ground that disposition. In fact, we say that what is essential to salt is whatever properties explain those dispositions, and it is those more basic properties that do the causing. So too it might be said for color. Dispositions do not cause anything, but rather the ground of those dispositions does. Color as a disposition cannot cause a perception of color. Instead, it must be the non-dispositional ground that causes experiences of color. But that means we have located color in the wrong place. Instead of speaking of color as a disposition, it now seems we should be considering the ground of that disposition to be the heart of color. And that might take us away from Dispositionalism and back to Physicalism, with all of its problems. Or maybe not, as some philosophers have sought here a third way.

As noted, these discussions of different kinds of Realism have only skimmed the surface. The broad strategies we have outlined, of course, can and have been developed in quite a number of different ways. Enough has been said, however, to both give a sense of these positions and to show the need some have felt for a completely different approach. We turn to that now, the broad strategy we have designated as Subjectivism.

b. Subjectivism

Recall that conflict between science and common sense over the status of color.

CS: Ordinary objects are colored.
PS: Basic scientific objects are not colored.

Our discussion of Realism has been an extended exploration of this conflict, with focus on preserving the truth of CS and common sense. Let us now cease attempting to reconcile these claims, and simply reject CS as false. Common sense is just wrong, we might claim. Objects are not colored in any sense, reduced or not; and thus we are free to embrace a scientific ontology which does not include color among the basic properties of its basic entities.

Common sense is wrong then, but it certainly does not seem wrong. The world presents itself as colored, afterall, and if it really is not colored, we are owed at least an explanation of how we could have been so wrong. Here is where Subjectivism gets its name and appeal. For while the world itself has no color, there are undeniably experiences of color. And while we will need to give a philosophical account of those experiences, we can say for now that color is subjective in the sense of being perceiver dependent, just as pain is. Objects can be round or square, but they are not colored. Since it does not make sense to say objects have the properties of pain and pleasure, we say that pain and pleasure, instead, are merely types of subjective experience. Those experiences may be caused by physical objects, but the qualities of pain and pleasure are in us, not in the objects. So too we may say for color.

In thus locating color within perceptual experience, we make it perceiver dependent, and thus, in some sense, cease to view color as part of the objective world. How we choose to account for experience itself, however, will give us different versions of Subjectivism.

i. Mentalism

Let us call any position that posits color as a genuine property of subjective, personal experience, a version of Mentalism. The inspiration for this view is René Descartes, who thought that color and other secondary qualities were merely sensations, and as such, mere occurrences within a mental substance. The parallel again with pain is instructive here. Pain and color, then, occur in a substance that is also the locus of thinking. As occurrences in a mental realm, they fall outside the scope of the physical sciences that study material substance.

Contemporary philosophy, however, has had little sympathy for this kind of substance dualism, whereby two distinct types of substances exist side by side. Not only does this mental substance fall outside the scope of the physical sciences, difficult questions about the connection and interaction of these independent substances arise. As we will see next, some have left the letter of mental substance behind, while retaining the spirit in a related, but slightly less problematic metaphysics, one that comes in handy when accounting for the nature of color.

In the earlier parts of the twentieth century, philosophers made much use of a special class of entities dubbed, sense-data. These are a class of particulars, or individuals, which have existence only in minds. They are often held to be private, special objects, of which each person has direct, infallible access to and knowledge of. Knowledge of sense-data in turn allegedly provided foundational knowledge on which all other knowledge rests. As for sense-data themselves, they were introduced to explain the appearance of perceptual qualities when there were in fact no such qualities in the physical objects one is perceiving. In a famous example, one could explain a perception of an elliptical coin, when presented with a coin that is really round, by claiming that the actual object of experience is an elliptically-shaped item (an elliptical sensum), which one experienced directly. Sense-data would be the bearers of properties we take physical objects to have, and so could explain the possibility of perceptual error.

With this metaphysics in hand, color can now be categorized as a property of such sense-data. Though the physical world may lack such properties as color, the world causes each of us to have experiences and present in such experiences would be special, private, mental entities that have the qualities in question. Presented then with an apple that really is not red or sweet, we have experiences of red sensa; sweet sensa, and so forth. We thereby account for the existence of such qualities–having them qualify these subjective, perceiver dependent entities, and we also explain our belief that the world is colored. We think there is color, because in fact there is, though we mistakenly believe the color of sense-data is really to be found in physical objects.

Sense-data themselves, however, have fallen on hard times, especially since the middle of the twentieth century as various philosophers objected both to their nature and the epistemological role they were to play. Though many are now reluctant to speak of sense-data as a class of particulars, some contemporary philosophers have preserved some of the functions of sense-data, and now speak of qualities that characterize our visual field, or perhaps that qualify our mental states or mental events. Color on this understanding is categorized as a “phenomenal property”, maintaining the Cartesian legacy that such properties are mind-dependent and subjective, but in a way that frees them of excessive ontological baggage.

ii. Eliminativism

In opposition to Mentalism, but still within what we have called Subjectivism, lies another popular position, Eliminativism. This view agrees that objects are not colored, but it does not wish to trade the color of objects for color as now an irreducible property of something inner or mental. Instead, it wishes to rob color of any ontological significance at all. We can still speak of our experiencing color, of course, but we are not to understand this as claiming that color does really exist, only now as a property of mental substance or of sense-data or of our visual field. Color experiences themselves, we could say, are to be reduced to non-color properties, just as Reductive Physicalism sought to reduce the color of objects to non-colored properties and relations. For Eliminativism the reduction of color experiences is to be to properties and facts about our visual processing systems, facts about the behavior of rods and cones, about transmission of information along neural pathways and the like. (We will explore some of the details below in our discussion of the universality of color experience.) In the end, nothing, anywhere, answers to our common sense description or account of color. That type of property just does not exist.

Put positively, Eliminativism can be understood as follows. Our experience of a seemingly colored world is the result of a systematic error. Simply put, we take features found in our visual experience and project them upon the world, mistakenly believing that color is “out there”–when in fact color is but subjective response to an achromatic reality. This Projectivism about color does not deny that this is an important projection, or that it might help us navigate the world more easily, or that we can continue to speak of the world as colored, but it does point out the fundamental error nevertheless. An analogy might help, and in fact much recent philosophy has involved discussion of the aptness of the following analogy.

In ordinary moral discourse, we are inclined to speak of an action as moral or immoral, right or wrong. We seem in these cases to be claiming that a particular act has (or lacks) a special, moral property or nature. Taken literally, though, such predication would commit us to the existence of rather strange properties, that is, rightness and/or wrongness, ones that are not easily described or explained. Wanting to avoid commitment to those properties, some have suggested a similar projectivist account. In this case, certain actions create in us feelings of pleasure or pain, approval or disapproval. We project these attitudes upon the world, taking the world to really have such properties, when in fact they are nothing but subjective responses. (Talk of “projection” in the psychoanalytic sense is another helpful parallel, where again, something “inner” is mistakenly claimed to be found “outside” us.)

Such Projectivism, as one way of developing Eliminativism, clears the road for a fully scientific account not only of objects, but now of perceivers as well. In particular, only properties that can do genuine explanatory work will be included, and color will be sorted into the group of properties that contribute nothing to our understanding of causal relations between objects and perceivers. There is a downside, however. Besides indicting common sense as systematically wrong, we are bound to be left with a nagging feeling that a most treasured property has completely disappeared. This has provoked some to reply along the following lines: “We started with a belief that objects are colored. Having reduced physical objects to items with only primary qualities, we were left to relocate color and similar qualities within perceivers. Now, however, we have made perceivers and their experiences also bereft of secondary qualities. Without color in the picture at all, we fail to explain how we thought there was color in the first place. How can we explain the appearance of color, our experience of color, now that color is nowhere to be found?”

This question might lead one to rethink the steps that led to this puzzling conclusion, and to raise the possibility that a mistake was made along the way. If so, where exactly did we go wrong, and what would be a better route? If not, how exactly then do we come to believe there is color, if it appears nowhere in our account of reality and perceivers? These difficult questions explain why philosophers continue to debate this interplay between what common sense says about color and what science would have us believe.

2. Color and Metaphysics

One should not conclude that the only philosophical questions about color involve science. The remaining portions of this article offer introduction to other important and exciting issues. In particular, we turn to some questions of metaphysics, and then turn to ones about the universality of color experience, questions that get at the heart of the nature of color from other perspectives.

To begin, consider how much energy we have devoted to explaining the color of objects. Is the color of an object a basic property, a disposition, a combination of micro-primary qualities? Let us pause, however, and ask about color itself. What exactly is color in the first place? What is the essence of this quality that is capable of being a property of objects, or a property of sensations, and so forth? (We can also ask, of course, “What is a quality? And what is the difference between qualities that are colors and those that are sounds?) Focusing our attention on a specific color seems to make things even harder. Consider the questions, “What is the essence of red?” “What is the difference between red and blue”? How do we even go about answering them? Let us explore some attempts.

a. Color Skepticism

Faced with such as question as, “What is the essence of red?” one might respond by pointing to something red, or by looking for a metaphor, claiming that red is like a trumpet sound. The first does not tell us much though–in fact, pointing at a red ball does not suffice to even indicate the redness as opposed to the round shape. Similarly, though metaphors might help convey something about the experience of red, they tell us little about the nature of redness. Can we do better? Can we actually articulate the nature of individual colors? Can we even say what colors in general are, in a rich, philosophically satisfying manner?

One possible source of the apparent difficulty is that we tend to think that the red we experience is something essentially private and subjective. We are drawn to a picture whereby the essence of red, or blue, or yellow for that matter, is given in sense-experience, where the experience itself is something ineffable. Just as it is hard, if not impossible, to articulate what a pain feels like, we may think that the qualitative difference between blue and red is similarly inexpressible. Let “color skepticism” be the view that the essence of color is ineffable, and let us explore the merits of such skepticism.

One source of the supposed ineffability of color, as we have seen, lies in the belief that color’s nature is revealed only in private experience. The language of color, and language as a whole, however, is public in the sense of both being suitable for reporting public events and learnable by appeal to public objects. How then could the allegedly private, subjective nature of color be reconciled with the public, intersubjective nature of language? Color skepticism gains a foothold here, for it seems it cannot. As a result, we are tempted to conclude that our experiences of color are akin to pain in being private, personal and ineffable. No surprise that many have been led to wonder whether the qualitative experience they associate with, say, red, is the same for each person, or instead, whether it is possible that what I experience as red, you experience as green, though we both use the same public word, “red”. Such color skepticism leads to this familiar problem, the Inverted Spectrum. At its worst, we imagine that all of our color experiences might be systematically different from another’s, though we all use “red” to refer to the color of firetrucks, “yellow” for the color of bananas, and so forth. In this case, each of us is trapped within our minds, forever cut-off from truly sharing our experiences of things that matter dearly to us.

How we might extricate ourselves from this depressing, solipsistic trap? One route is to rethink our starting point, namely that there is nothing more to say about red than pointing to red objects or reverting to metaphor. As an alternative, some have sought to articulate the metaphysical nature of color in a surprising direction–by understanding the intrinsic features of individual colors as a product of their relations to other colors. These relations are known as “internal relations” and to them we turn.

b. Color and Internal Relations

First we need to distinguish such internal relations from so-called external relations. External relations are ones in which the relation plays no role in making the relata the relata that they are. For instance, my glass of water is externally related to the table. The relation, “being on top of” is external in that it is not part of the nature or essence of the glass or table to be in that relation. Were the glass and table to cease to being so related neither will undergo a change in their nature. They will not cease to be the things they are. The relata here are external to each other in the sense of not depending on each, or the relation, for their identity.

In contrast we have internal relations. For internal relations, the relations are essential to the being and nature of the related items. Without that particular relation, an entity would not be the thing that it is. To say that colors are internally related to colors would mean that the natures of individual colors depend on the relations those colors have to other colors, to other members the color-array. Orange is related to red and yellow in a particular, unique way, for instance. That relation therefore helps make orange the color it is–that relation as well as the other ones that orange bears to other colors. No other color has those particular relations, and thus no other color is orange. Put differently, orange would cease to be orange were it to not have that relational structure to other colors. (Another example is numbers. Seven would not be the number it is, for instance, were it not between 6 and 8.)

To speak then of a particular color requires reference to its relational place within a color array. What is the nature of the relation between colors? Most abstractly, it is that relation which includes only colors. More specifically, we might say that it is the betweenness relation colors bear to one another. Orange, for instance, is between yellow and red, while green is between blue and yellow, and so forth. Such betweenness relations capture the essence of color. Taken as a whole, these complex betweenness relations can be modeled, allowing us to understand the logical structure of the entire color array. And though many models have been proposed, one particularly illuminating one captures these betweenness relations by modeling color’s structure on that of a double cone. (We can even now speak of the difference between different types of qualities by talking about their different spatial models–color is nicely modeled on a double cone, sound perhaps by a spiral staircase, with each octave recognized as another turn on the staircase.)

The following diagram helps illustrate the structure of color, making use of the HSL (hue, saturation, lightness) model. We can even use it to spell out in some detail a claim about a particular color’s nature and its betweenness relations.

Relying as we have on internal relations might seem paradoxical. On the one hand, each color has its proper place within the color array because of the particular color it is. On the other a color is the particular color it is because of that place within the color array. This suggests colors have their intrinsic properties because of their relations–as opposed to saying they have the relations they do because of their intrinsic property. But what could be plainer than saying red is what it is because of its intrinsic properties? The intrinsic nature of color, we might object, is prior to any of its relations and it is that essence we should try to articulate. Have not we forgotten this important point? Have not we ignored the intrinsic nature of color, and thus what is most important about color in the first place? In reply, it is acknowledged that this account of internal relations does appeal to the relations a color has to other colors in order to individuate it. But, crucially, that does not make the relations conceptually or ontologically prior to colors’ intrinsic properties. For to make sense of the particular relations a color has we have to return to the relata, the color itself. A color has the particular relations it does because of the color it is, just as we want to say. The difference is that on this story, the relata and the relation are intimately and necessarily involved. The relationship and dependence goes in both directions. We are talking about internal relations here, after all. As such, the relata and the relation figure as essential elements. Both balance each other, making both important, but neither prior. That is what is so special about internal relations. In conclusion, we can now say that we have still paid proper respect to the intrinsic nature color.

With this account in place, perhaps we finally have an answer to the color skeptic. We now have something, in fact a lot, to say about each color. True, we need to speak of other colors to explain what a single color is, but we have gone well beyond mere pointing or metaphor. We say what a color is by talking about how it relates to other colors, about its color relationships, its intrinsic properties that make for those relations, and those relations that make for those properties. If that is not good enough to satisfy our skeptic, we might begin to wonder whether the skeptic is willing to be convinced.

3. Is Color Experience Universal?

A final issue we will discuss in this article concerns the universality of color experience. We have already seen one threat to the notion that we all experience color the same way, namely the possibility of an inverted spectrum. A deeper threat comes from another direction, this time borne from wondering about the connection between language and perception. An important theme in the background of this threat lies in the rise and development of a view according to which our perceptual experience is mediated by our language. This has been an important strand in post-WWII philosophy, and as such draws on various themes that fall far outside the scope of this article. We can gain enough of an appreciation of the issue by considering for starters a relatively uncontroversial sense in which our familiarity with a concept influences what we see. To use a well-worn example, a physicist looking at a technical apparatus in a lab sees, in some sense, something different that what the layperson sees and experiences. In this way, different concepts can play some role in what is seen. We move from this innocuous example to tougher ones when we wonder whether different cultures that have completely different languages experience the same world. Or, instead, do the different linguistic resources they bring to experience give them experiences of quite different worlds? It is not hard to be swayed to a perspective from which we see such different languages as yielding very different worlds of experience. Now take these general questions and apply them to experiences of color. Would speakers of languages that have different color terms see the world differently, see different colors?

a. Linguistic Determinism

A particularly strong version of the view that language influences perception was advanced by the anthropologists, Whorf and Sapir. On their view, language plays such an essential role in perception that cultures that use different language can be said to inhabit quite different worlds. What we all see, what we take ourselves to touch, to conceive as real, is a function of language. Vary the language and you change the world experienced. Dubbed the thesis of Linguistic Determinism, this view clearly has interesting implication for color experience once it is realized that there is great diversity in color language across cultures. There are well-documented languages that have only 2 color terms, or three, or only four, and so forth.

What then would Linguistic Determinism have us expect for people who speak a language with only three color terms, for instance? Presumably, if that thesis of determinism is correct, those people would experience only three colors. We would expect these people to simply not be aware of the colors we have terms for; they would fail to make the color discriminations we make, and they would organize their color field in very different ways than we do. This hypothesis was put to the test in the 1960’s by the researchers, Berlin and Kay. Compiling data from a great number of languages, their results seem to contradict the Whorf-Sapir thesis and open a whole range of questions and interesting debates

b. Berlin and Kay

To help appreciate the significance of their findings, we need to distinguish a color’s “foci” from its “boundary.” When presented with an array of color samples (such as ones found at a paint store) we can ask how many of those samples are properly called by a certain color. We could ask, that is, how many of these samples are appropriately called “red”, and where do we draw the line between samples that are red and those that are not? To answer these questions is to speak of the red’s boundary. We might also ask about what is the best sample or paradigmatic sample of red. This is to ask about red’s foci, or more generally, to look for focal samples.

Berlin and Kay found, quite interestingly, that though there are differences across cultures of color boundaries for shared color terms, there was significant consensus on what counted as a focal color–even across languages with very different numbers of color terms. So, in a culture that had only three basic color words, say ones for “white”, “black”, and “red”, people in that culture would point to the same samples as the foci for each of these colors as people with 11 basic color terms, such as English speakers. What they consider as truly red, or white, or black, would be nearly the same samples that we do, though we carve up the world with many different color terms. On the face of it, this suggests something quite other than Whorf-Sapir would have us expect. Something besides color vocabulary seems to be at work in our experience of color. Why else would we all gravitate to the same samples, when for some what is red would presumably include many more colors than us? After all, with only three terms to cover the whole range of color, many more things would have to be called “white” or “black” or “red” in this example. Why would certain samples stand out, even when so many other things are conceived and experienced as red?

In addition, Berlin and Kay found that languages exhibit great similarities on which color terms they have; and great similarities in the relationships between differing numbers of color terms. The following graph summarizes their results, where movement from left to right indicates what color terms would be added as a language increases its number of terms.

Here we see that if a language has two color terms, the terms are “white” and “black”. If a language has a third term, it is “red”; if more than three, then either “green” or “yellow”; and next the other “green” or “yellow” term; and so on. This suggests, as they interpreted it, a development suitably conceived as evolutionary. Thus if a language evolves from two colors to three, the one it will add will be “red”, then “green or “yellow”, and so forth.

What is the philosophical significance of these findings, if true? Simply put, they again suggest that there is something other than language that determines what colors are seen. Berlin and Kay conclude that there are universal, non-trivial constraints on color terms. Color experience is not simply a function of a language’s terms and arbitrary conventions. Instead, there seems something about how the world is that causes different speakers to experience certain colors as best samples, to develop terms for “red” before terms for “brown”, for privileging “white” and “black” over “pink”, and so forth.

If not language, what would explain these findings? One answer comes from facts about the biology of color perception, facts about how our visual system processes certain kinds of electromagnetic radiation, that is, light. (These are the very facts our previously discussed “color-eliminativist” might offer to show that there really is no such thing as color, that is, might make use of to reduce color experience to facts, properties, and relations that make no mention of color at all. Thus what follows can be called upon to serve two functions–explain similarity of color experience across language, and also be used by a color eliminativist to reduce away color. Importantly, these issues are logically independent, and a solution to one problem need have no bearing on the truth of the other.)

Here is a quick summary of the proposed biological account. Our visual system includes rods and cones. Cones are responsible for color vision and do so with three different types of cones. Two of these cones operate according to what is known as opponent-processing. For these two types of cones, they each have two cells, one which has its rate of firing increase when hit by a certain range of light and decrease when another range of light hits it, and a second cell that operates just the opposite way. For example, there is a cell that maximizes its output when hit by light around 610 nm and is at its lowest output around 500 nm. It sits alongside another cell that works just the opposite–its maximum is around 500 nm and its lowest is at 610 nm. (Call these our Y+B- and Y-B+ cells, respectively.) Thus when the cone with this cell package is hit by that 610 nm light, there will be a pure, highly stimulated response as the Y+B- cell will be at its highest, and the Y-B+ cell will be at its quietist. 610 nm happens to be the range of light we call yellow; and thus when this cone is hit by that light, it will give its purest, most intense output of energy. Yellow will be experienced, in other words, in a pure, intense manner. But when the received light is at around 440 nm, this Y+B- cell is at its lowest output, but its partner, the Y-B+ cell, is at its highest output. Blue then also can appear as a particularly strong, pure color. Other places where we get these pure peaks of cell stimulation occur at 520 nm and 660 nm–the very ranges that correspond to green and red respectively. Here we can speak of our R-G+ and R+G- cells. (White and black have their own cells, but these do not work in opposition to each other, so both the black cell and the white cell can be activated at the same time, yielding experiences of different shades of gray.)

This all suggest that any person with a normal operating visual system is going to experience certain ranges of light with intense neural stimulation which happen to correspond to the four basic colors: yellow, red, blue, and green (yes, green is a primary color when it considering our visual system.) And it also explains why no one seems to experience reddish greens–for when the “red” cell is active, the “green” cell is not. We can only have one or the other, and not both. Further, these facts might be able to explain why different speakers in different languages hone in on the same color samples–because for everyone these samples trigger the same intense cell stimulation. Our shared judgments about focal colors, as well as why all people gravitate towards certain colors in a similar order, now seem explainable. And the explanation goes beyond what language creates, contrary to Whorf-Sapir.

To be sure, there are many questions left–such as why it is that red always is the first color to appear in languages after “white” and “black” even though other colors trigger similarly intense responses. So too have Berlin/Kay’s results been subjected to many criticisms and objections, from the philosophical to the methodological. What emerges then is a fascinating debate the ranges across numerous disciplines. In a way, that seems most proper and fitting. For color appeals to all who can see it, and it makes sense to suppose that we are still drawn to color, whatever our intellectual interests, just as we have been since we were kids.

4. References and Further Reading

a. Overviews and General Discussions

Berlin, B., & Kay, P. (1999). Basic color terms : their universality and evolution. Stanford, Calif: Center for the Study of Language and Information.
- The landmark book that summarizes their cross-cultural findings of color terms, boundaries, and foci.
Byrne, A., & Hilbert, D. R. (1997). Readings on color. Cambridge, Mass: MIT Press.
- This two volume set contains a wide range of important article on various issues on color. Volume 1 is on the philosophy of color, and the second volume on the science. Besides containing numerous landmark articles, there is a detailed bibliography and glossary of terms. A must have set for those wishing to explore the various debates in more detail.
Kay, P., McDaniel, C. “The Linguistic Significance of the Meaning of Basic Color Terms”. Language, vol. 54, 1978, pp.610-46.
- Provides a biological based explanation for the anthropological findings in Berlin/Kay.
Harrison, Bernard. (1973). Form and Content. Oxford: Basil Blackwell.
- An extended discussion of what we have called “color skepticism”, with a detailed account of color as a system of internal relations. Covers many issues in a careful, interesting manner.
Wittgenstein, L., & Anscombe, G. E. M. (1978). Remarks on colour. Oxford [Eng.]: B. Blackwell.
- An interesting, but difficult, examination of a number of puzzles about color. Hard going but shows a brilliant mind struggling to make sense of difficult problems about color.

b. Specific Positions

Armstrong, D. M. (1987) “Smart and the secondary qualities.” In Metaphysics and Morality: Essays in Honour of J. J. C. Smart, ed. P. Pettit, R. Sylvan, and J. Norman. Oxford: Blackwell. Reprinted as chapter 3 of Readings on Color, vol. 1.)
- Classic statement of Physicalism.
Cornman, J. “Can Eddington’s `two tables’ be identical?”. Australasian Journal of Philosophy vol 52, 1974. pp. 22-38.
- A defender of Non-Reductive Realism.
Hardin, C. L. (1988). Color for Philosophers: Unweaving the Rainbow. Indianapolis: Hackett Pub. Co.
- Written by a philosopher who knows lots of the science of color perception, this book provides an excellent introduction to debates over the scientific status of color, and provides an extended argument for what we have called Color Eliminativism.
Jackson, F., and R. Pargetter. “An objectivist’s guide to subjectivism about colour.” Revue Internationale de Philosophie. vol. 41. 1987. pp.127-41. (Reprinted as chapter 6 of Readings on Color, vol. 1.)
- An alternative to Physicalism about color.
Johnston, M. “How to speak of the colors”. Philosophical Studies, vol. 68, 2 1992. pp. 21-63.
- Extended defense of Dispositionalism.
McDowell, J. “Values and Secondary Qualities”, in Ted Honderich, ed., (1985) Morality and Objectivity. Routledge & Kegan Paul.
- Discusses the pros and cons of a Projectivist strategy that compares secondary qualities and moral properties.
Peacocke, C. “Colour concepts and colour experience”. Synthese vol. 58, 1984. pp. 365-82. (Reprinted as chapter 5 of Readings on Color, vol. 1.)
- Another version of Dispositionalism.
Sellars, W. “Philosophy and the Scientific Image of Man” in Science, Perception and Reality. (1991) Ridgview Publishing Company.
- A difficult but interesting argument against Eliminativism, in favor of a different version of Subjectivism.
Shoemaker, S. “Phenomenal character.” Noûs. vol. 28, 1994. pp. 21-38. (Reprinted as chapter 12 of Readings on Color, vol. 1.)
- From a defender of what we have called Phenomenal Subjectivism.

Author Information

Eric M. Rubenstein
Email: erubenst@iup.edu
Indiana University of Pennsylvania
U. S. A.

Personal Identity

What does being the person that you are, from one day to the next, necessarily consist in? This is the question of personal identity, and it is literally a question of life and death, as the correct answer to it determines which types of changes a person can undergo without ceasing to exist. Personal identity theory is the philosophical confrontation with the most ultimate questions of our own existence: who are we, and is there a life after death? In distinguishing those changes in a person that constitute survival from those changes in a person that constitute death, a criterion of personal identity through time is given. Such a criterion specifies, insofar as that is possible, the necessary and sufficient conditions for the survival of persons.

One popular criterion, associated with Plato, Descartes and a number of world religions, is that persons are immaterial souls or pure egos. On this view, persons have bodies only contingently, not necessarily; so they can live after bodily death. Even though this so-called Simple View satisfies certain religious or spiritual predilections, it faces metaphysical and epistemological obstacles, as we shall see.

Another intuitively appealing view, championed by John Locke, holds that personal identity is a matter of psychological continuity. According to this view, in order for a person X to survive a particular adventure, it is necessary and sufficient that there exists, at a time after the adventure, a person Y who psychologically evolved out of X. This idea is typically cashed out in terms of overlapping chains of direct psychological connections, as those causal and cognitive connections between beliefs, desires, intentions, experiential memories, character traits, and so forth. This Lockean view is well suited for thought experiments conducted from first-person points of view, such as body swaps or tele-transportation, but it, too, faces obstacles. For example, on this view, it appears to be possible for two future persons to be psychologically continuous with a presently existing person. Can one really become two? In response to this problem, some commentators have suggested that, although our beliefs, memories, and intentions are of utmost importance to us, they are not necessary for our identity, our persistence through time.

A third criterion of personal identity is that we are our bodies, that is to say, that personal identity is constituted by some brute physical relation between, for example, different bodies or different life-sustaining systems at different times. Although this view is still somewhat unpopular, developments about personal identity theory in the 1990s promise an ideological change, as versions of the so-called somatic criterion, associated with Eric Olson and Paul Snowdon, attract a continuously growing number of adherents.

The aim of this article is to (1) add precision to the problem of personal identity, (2) state a number of theories of personal identity and give arguments for and against them, (3) formulate “the paradox of identity,” which proposes to show that posing the persistence question, in conjunction with a number of plausible assumptions, leads to a contradiction, and (4) explain how Derek Parfit’s theory of persons attempts to answer this paradox.

Understanding the Problem of Personal Identity
1. Criteria and the Identity Relation
2. Personhood
Theories of Personal Identity
The Paradox of Personal Identity
1. Fission
2. The Paradox
Parfit and the Unimportance of Personal Identity
References and Further Reading

1. Understanding the Problem of Personal Identity

The persistence question, the question of what personal identity over time consists in, is literally a question of life and death: answers to it determine, insofar as that is possible, the conditions under which we survive, or cease to exist in the course of, certain adventures. These adventures do not have to be theoretically as fancy as the cases, to be discussed later, of human fission or brain swaps: a theory of personal identity tells us whether we can live through the acquisition of complex cognitive capacities in our development from fetus to person, or whether we have survived car accidents if we find ourselves in a persistent vegetative state. Furthermore, theories of personal identity have ethical and metaphysical implications of considerable magnitude: in conjunction with certain normative premises they may support the justification or condemnation of infanticide or euthanasia, or they could prove or falsify certain aspects of our religious outlook, in deciding the questions of how and whether we can be resurrected and whether we are possessors of souls whose existence conditions are identical with ours. It is not surprising, therefore, that most great philosophers have attempted to solve the problem of personal identity, or have committed themselves to metaphysical systems that have substantial implications with regards to the problem, and that most religious belief systems give explicit answers to the persistence question. Neither is it surprising that virtually everybody holds a pre-theoretical theory of personal identity, if only in the sense of having beliefs about afterlives and the meaning of death. The task of solving the metaphysical problem of personal identity essentially involves answering the question of how the phenomenon or principle in virtue of which “entities like us” persist through time is to be specified, under the widely but not universally accepted premises that there is such a phenomenon or principle and that it can be specified. We are concerned, in other words, with the truth-makers of personal identity statements: what makes it true that our statement that an entity X at time t₁ and an entity Y at time t₂ are identical, if X and Y are entities like us?

a. Criteria and the Identity Relation

Answers to the persistence question often provide a criterion of personal identity. A criterion is a set of non-trivial necessary and sufficient conditions that determines, insofar as that is possible, whether distinct temporally indexed person-stages are stages of one and the same continuant person. (A temporally indexed person-stage is a slice of a continuant person that extends in three spatial dimensions but has no temporal extension.) To say that C is a necessary condition for E is to say that if E is the case, then C is the case as well, and to say that C is a sufficient condition for E is to say that if C is the case, then E is the case as well. Consequently, to specify such a criterion is to give an account of what personal identity necessarily consists in.

Let us distinguish between numerical identity and qualitative identity (exact similarity): X and Y are numerically identical iff X and Y are one thing rather than two, while X and Y are qualitatively identical iff, for the set of non-relational properties F₁…F_n of X, Y only possesses F₁…F_n. (A property may be called “non-relational” if its being borne by a substance is independent of the relations in which property or substance stand to other properties or substances.) Personal identity is an instance of the relation of numerical identity; investigations into the nature of the former, therefore, must respect the formal properties that govern the latter. The concept of identity is uniquely defined by (a) the logical laws of congruence: if X is identical with Y, then all non-relational properties borne by X are borne by Y, or formally “∀(x, y)[(x = y) → (Fx = Fy)]; and (b) reflexivity: every X is identical with itself, or formally “∀x(x = x). (Note that congruence and reflexivity entail that identity is symmetric, “∀(x, y)[(x = y) → (y = x)], and transitive, “∀(x, y, z)[((x = y) & (y = z)) → (x = z)]). [Note: ∀(x, y) is an abbreviation of (∀x)(∀y).]

Grasp of the notion of numerical identity, to be sure, is essential to our ability to distinguish between the events of picking out one thing more often than once and picking out more than one thing. Although exact similarity is, by congruence, a necessary condition for synchronic personal identity, it is neither necessary nor sufficient for diachronic personal identity, that is to say, the persistence of a person over time: two person-slices at different times could be qualitatively identical slices of different people or qualitatively distinct slices of the same person. This is not to say, however, that it is ruled out that lack of similarity over time may obliterate numerical personal identity: depending on what personal identity consists in, certain qualitative changes in a person’s psychology or physiology may kill the person. The question a criterion of personal identity answers is: what kind of changes does a person survive?

This gives a distinctive sense to the claim that a criterion of personal identity is to be constitutive, not merely evidential: in order for a relation R to be constitutive for personal identity, it must be the case that, necessarily, if some past or future Y stands in an R-relation to X, then X is identical with Y. Hence, many elements of our successful everyday reidentification practices, such as physical appearance, fingerprints, or signatures, are inadequate if considered as constituting ingredients of personal identity relations: for example, if the man in the crowd is wearing a Yankees jacket, this might be sufficient evidence for you to conclude that he is your friend Larry. However, wearing a Yankees jacket is not what it is for Larry to persist through time: neither did Larry come into existence when he wore the jacket for the first time nor does he die when he takes it off.

Does the logic of the concept of identity impose further restraints on the concept of personal identity? Some commentators believe that identity is an intrinsic relation, that is, that if two person-stages at different times are stages of one and the same person, that will be true only in virtue of the intrinsic relation between these two stages (cf. Noonan 1989; Wiggins 2001). Others hold identity to be necessarily determinate, that is, that it is necessarily false that sometimes there is no answer to the question of whether X is identical with Y. These commentators typically reason as follows: suppose that it is indeterminate that X is identical with Y. Since it is determinate that X is identical with X, under the assumption that congruence and predicate logic apply, X must be determinately identical with Y. Therefore, by modus tollens, if X is not determinately identical with Y, X is not identical with Y (cf. Evans 1985; Wiggins 2001). Consequently, the question does in fact have an answer, and the claim that identity is indeterminate is self-contradictory. This conclusion is strengthened, in the case of personal identity, by the widely shared intuition that even if the identity of some objects might be indeterminate, this could not be true of the identity of persons: one cannot, it seems, be a bit dead and a bit alive in the same way in which one cannot be a bit pregnant. As it turns out, however, there may be good reasons to deny both the intrinsicness and the determinacy of personal identity (cf. 3.a.; 3.b.).

b. Personhood

While the formal properties of the concept of identity are necessary constraints on our discussion, the truth of our identity judgments is subject to material conditions of correctness, which these formal properties cannot provide. These material conditions must be supplied by the nature of the relata judged to stand in an identity relation. The obvious suggestion is that, given that we are dealing with personal identity, these relata are person-stages located at different times. This proposal, however, violates the requirement that the persistence question ought to specify its relata without presupposing an answer: should we choose to accept a definition in the vicinity of Locke’s characterization of a person as a “thinking, intelligent being, that has reason and reflection, and can consider itself as itself, the same thinking thing in different times and places” (1689, II.xxvii.9), then those criteria of personal identity that sanction the identity of a person at one time with a non-person at another time are categorically ruled out. Fetuses, infants, or human beings in a persistent vegetative state, for example, plainly do not fulfill the criteria envisaged by Locke. As a result, since these beings do not possess cognitive capacities, if they do at all, that qualitatively attain those of thinking beings, couching the persistence question in terms of persons entails that none of us has ever been a fetus or infant or ever will be a human vegetable (Olson 1997a; Mackie 1999). To be sure, these initially baffling claims could be true. However, since these are clearly substantial questions about our persistence, we should not consider ourselves justified to settle the matter by definition. Consequently, we should prefer vagueness over chauvinism and pose the persistence question in terms of the wider notion of human being, postponing the question of whether and in what sense the notions of person and human being ought to be distinguished: for any person X and any human being Y at different times t₁ and t₂, if X at t₁ is numerically identical with Y at t₂, what makes this claim necessarily true?

2. Theories of Personal Identity

In order to discover what your pre-philosophical attitude towards this question is, ask yourself the following: what does a supernatural being have to do in order to resurrect you after you die? Collect a few possible answers and ask yourself whether the resulting being, the freshly created being that is now a candidate for being identical with you before you died, is in fact you. For example, do you believe that

…the supernatural being could have given you a body which bears no physical continuity or causal relation to the one you possessed before your death, or that it could have resurrected you, in some sense or other, as a bodiless being?
…it could have given a new form or content to your psychology, that is, that it is not necessary or sufficient for the “resurrected you” to remember your actions or experiences and that there do not have to be any causal connections between the actions and experiences of you before you died and the”resurrected you”?
…the question of whether or not the resulting person is you depends on the existence, in the resurrected person, of something that one might call “a soul”?

If you believe any of these options, then you must also believe, respectively, that

…a physiological criterion of personal identity is false.
…a psychological criterion of personal identity is false.
…the Simple View of personal identity is true.

Let us discuss these theories of personal identity in more detail.

a. The Simple View

Some commentators believe that there are no informative, non-trivial persistence conditions for people, that is, that personal persistence is an ultimate and unanalyzable fact (cf. Chisholm 1976; Lowe 1996; Merricks 1998; Shoemaker & Swinburne 1984). While psychological and physiological continuities are evidential criteria, these do not constitute necessary and/or sufficient conditions for personal identity. We must distinguish between two versions of this view. One version is that personal identity is non-reductive and wholly non-informative, denying that personal identity follows from anything other than itself. This makes the label Identity Mysticism (“IM“) most appropriate (cf. Zimmerman 1998):

IM: X at t₁ is identical to Y at t₂ iff X at t₁ is identical to Y at t₂,

Identity Mysticism plays only an indirect role in contemporary personal identity theory. Although it may be poorly understood, due to limitations of space this article will disregard the view. IM is to be distinguished from a more popular version of the simple view, according to which personal identity relations are weakly reductive (WR) and in independence non-informative (INI):

WR-INI: X at t₁ is identical to Y at t₂ iff there is some fact F₁ about X at t₁, and some fact F₂ about Y at t₂, and F₁ and F₂ are irreducible to facts about the subjects’ psychology or physiology, and X at t₁ is identical with Y at t₂ in virtue of the fact that the propositions stating F₁ and F₂ differ only insofar as that “X” and “t₁” occur in the former where “Y” and “t₂” occur in the latter.

WR-INI is weakly reductive in the sense that, while the identity relation in question can be reduced to a further domain, the further domain itself typically exhibits elements of non-reducibility and/or resistance to full physical explanation. In their most prominent variants, these elements are due to references to souls, Cartesian Egos or other spiritual or immaterial substances and/or properties. Initially the idea underlying this claim may appear prejudicial; ultimately it is based on a number of widespread but not universally accepted beliefs about the naturalness of the world and the nature, validity and theoretical implications of physicalism. According to this general stance, either both psychological and physiological continuity relations are fully reducible to a domain in which physical explanations are couched, perhaps in terms of the basic elements of a final and unified theory of physics, or they belong themselves to such a domain.

WR-INI may entail IM but does not so necessarily: it is conceivable that personal identity relations consist in something which is itself neither identical with nor reducible to a spiritual substance nor identical with nor reducible to aggregates or parts of psychologies and physiologies. In fact, Descartes’ own view that personal identity is determined by “vital union” relations between pure Egos and bodies, with the persistence of the Ego being regarded as sufficient for the persistence of the person but the person not being wholly identifiable with the Ego, could be a weakly reductive view of persons. It is merely weakly reductive, however, because the identity of the phenomenon that specifies the necessary and sufficient conditions for personal identity does not itself follow from anything other than itself. While a weakly reductive criterion of personal identity relations is explicable in terms of the identities of phenomena other than persons, the identities of these phenomena themselves are not explicable in other terms: their identity may be, as we would suppose “soul identity” to be, “strict and philosophical”, and not merely “loose and popular” (Butler 1736).

Nowadays, the Simple View is disparaged as a theory only maintained by thinkers whose religious or spiritual commitments outweigh the reasons that speak against their views on personal identity. This is due to the fact that it is assumed that a theory of personal identity cannot be weakly reductive without involving appeal to discredited spiritual substances or committing itself either to the acknowledgment of yet unrecognized physical entities or to an Identity Mysticism on the level of persons. As a consequence, many philosophers think that the problems that infiltrate dualism and Cartesian theories of the soul, such as the alleged impossibilities to circumscribe the ontological status of souls and to explain how a soul can interact with a body, render the Simple View equally problematic. Although the options mentioned are exceedingly difficult to defend, why should they have to be regarded as the only options available to the Simple Theorist? Arguably, many respectable philosophical ideologies, such as conceptualism or Neo-Kantianism, may issue in theories of personal identity along Simple lines without appeal to Cartesian Egos. (Note, however, that these ideologies, with regards to the problem of the persistence of people, may also be, and in fact have been, construed along physiological or psychological lines). This suggests that we do not only need a better understanding, and above all more promising articulations, of the Simple View, but also a new taxonomy of theories of personal identity: the traditional division of theories into Simple, Psychological and Physical, even if maintained here by the author of this entry, may not be the best way of viewing the matter.

b. Reductionism (1): General Features

Modern day personal identity theory takes place mainly within reductionist assumptions, concentrating on the relative merits of different criteria of identity and related methodological questions. Reductionist theories of personal identity share the contention that…

Reduction: Facts about personal identity stand in an adequate reduction-relation to sets of sub-personal facts SF₁… SF_n about psychological and/or physiological continuities in such a way as to issue in biconditionals of the form “X at t₁ is identical to Y at t₂ iff X at t₁ and Y at t₂ stand in a continuity-relation fully describable by SF_x.”

Thus, any given set of sub-personal facts will impose demands, in forms of necessary and sufficient conditions, upon the kinds of adventures a subject can survive in persisting from t₁ to t₂. The sets of necessary and sufficient conditions determined by these sets of sub-personal facts constitute the various criteria of personal identity. It must be noted that the biconditionals in question need not to be understood in such a way as that circularity is an objection to them: provided that concepts other than “person” feature in the analysans, these biconditionals, by exhibiting connections with collateral and independently intelligible concepts, may be genuinely elucidatory even if the concept to be analyzed features on both sides of the equation (cf. McDowell 1997; Wittgenstein 1922, 3.263).

Only when the concepts “person” and “personal identity” become the target of what may be referred to as an authentic reduction circularities become vicious. The need for the distinction between authentic and inauthentic reductions arises due to an equivocation that ought not to confuse the present discussion: reductionisms in personal identity theory often take forms, if regarded for example as sets of supervenience claims, that are deemed, in other areas of analytic philosophy, as distinctively non-reductionist. Let us speak of authentic reductions if the ontological status of members of the reduced category is, in a way to be made precise, diminished in favor of the allegedly “more fundamental” existence-status of members of the reducing category. The question of whether an authentic reductionism about persons must claim that it is not only able to give a criterion of personal identity without presupposing personal identity but also that facts about persons are describable without using the concept “person” is a matter of current controversy (cf. Behrendt 2003; Cassam 1989; 1992; Johnston 1997; McDowell 1997; Parfit 1984; 1999; forthcoming; cf. also 2.d.).

In a search for the necessary and sufficient conditions for the sustenance of personal identity relations between subjects, which type of continuity-relations could SF describe? There are two main contenders, physiological continuity-relations and psychological continuity-relations, which will be discussed in turn.

c. Reductionism (2): Psychological Approaches

Psychological Criteria of personal identity hold that psychological continuity relations, that is, overlapping chains of direct psychological connections, as those causal and cognitive connections between beliefs, desires, intentions, experiential memories, character traits and so forth, constitute personal identity (cf. Locke 1689, II.xxvii.9-29; Parfit 1971a; 1984; Perry 1972; Shoemaker 1970; Shoemaker & Swinburne 1984).

Two apparently physiological theories of personal identity are at bottom psychological, namely (i) the Brain Criterion, which holds that the spatiotemporal continuity of a single functioning brain constitutes personal identity; and (ii) the Physical Criterion, which holds that, necessarily, the spatiotemporal continuity of that which sustains the continuous psychological life of a human being over time, which is, contingently, a sufficient part of the brain that must remain in order to be the brain of a living person, constitutes personal identity (cf. Nagel 1971). These approaches are at bottom psychological because they single out, as the constituting factors of personal identity, the psychological continuity of the subject. Consider a test case. Imagine there to be a tribe of beings who are in all respects like human beings, except for the fact that their brains and livers have swapped bodily functions: their brains regulate, synthesize, store, secrete, transform, and break down many different substances in the body, while their livers are responsible for their cognitive capacities, basic integrated postural and locomotor movement sequences, perception, instincts, emotions, thinking, and other integrative activities. Imagine the brain criterion to be true for human beings. Would we have sufficient reason to believe the brain criterion to be true for members of the tribe in question as well, if we were aware of all facts about their physiologies? No, precisely because the brain criterion is true for human beings, a liver criterion would have to be true for members of this tribe. There is nothing special about the 1.3 kilograms of grey mass that we carry around in our skulls, except for the fact that this mass is the seat of our cognitive capacities.

We can further distinguish between three versions of the psychological criterion: the Narrow version demands psychological continuity to be caused “normally,” the Wide version permits any reliable cause, and the Widest version allows any cause to be sufficient to secure psychological continuity (cf. Parfit 1984). The Narrow version, we may note, is logically equivalent to the Physical Criterion.

One might think that brain criterion and physical criterion, to varying degrees, combine the best of both worlds: both acknowledge the vital function psychological continuity plays in our identity judgments while at the same time admitting of the importance of physiological instantiation. In fact, however, the opposite is the case: the appeal to physiology introduces an unacceptable element of contingency into the answers to the persistence question envisaged by defenders of these criteria. A criterion of personal identity tells us what our persistence necessarily consists in, which means that it must be able to deliver a verdict in possible scenarios that is consistent with its verdicts in ordinary cases. One scenario that has been widely debated is the following:

Teletransportation

At t₁, X enters a teletransporter, which, before destroying X, creates an exact blueprint of X’s physical and psychological states. The information is sent to a replicator device on Mars, which at t₂ creates a qualitatively identical duplicate, Y (cf. Parfit 1984). Our alleged intuition: since Y at t₂ shares with X at t₁ all memories, character traits, and other psychological characteristics, X and Y are identical. Alleged conclusion: should teletransportation be reliable, all proposed criteria but the Wide and Widest versions of the Psychological Criterion are false.

Should teletransportation be unreliable, all criteria of personal identity but the Widest version of the Psychological Criterion are false. Consequently, should appeal to such scenarios as Teletransportation be acceptable and should the intuition above be widely shared, the brain criterion and physical criterion are false.

d. Quasi-Psychology

Many people regard the idea that our persistence is intrinsically related to our psychology as obvious. The problem of cashing out this conviction in theoretical terms, however, is notoriously difficult. Psychological continuity relations are to be understood in terms of overlapping chains of direct psychological connections, that is, those causal and cognitive connections between beliefs, desires, intentions, experiential memories, character traits and so forth. This statement avoids two obvious problems.

First, some attempts to cash out personal identity relations in psychological terms appeal exclusively to direct psychological connections. These accounts face the problem that identity is a transitive relation (see 1.a.) while many psychological connections are not. Take memory as an example: suppose that Paul broke the neighbor’s window as a kid, an incident he remembers vividly when he starts working as a primary school teacher in his late 20s. As an old man, Paul remembers his early years as a teacher, but has forgotten ever having broken the neighbor’s window. Assume, for reductio, that personal identity consists in direct memory connections. In that case the kid is identical with the primary school teacher and the primary school teacher is identical with the old man; the old man, however, is not identical with the kid. Since this conclusion violates the transitivity of identity (which states that if an X is identical with a Y, and the Y is identical with a Z, then the X must be identical with the Z), personal identity relations cannot consist in direct memory connections. Appeal to overlapping layers or chains of psychological connections avoids the problem by permitting indirect relations: according to this view, the old man is identical with the kid precisely because they are related to each other by those causal and cognitive relations that connect kid and teacher and teacher and old man.

Second, memory alone is not necessary for personal identity, as lack of memory through periods of sleep or coma do not obliterate one’s survival of these states. Appeal to causal and cognitive connections which relate not only memory but other psychological aspects is sufficient to eradicate the problem. Let us say that we are dealing with psychological connectedness if the relations in question are direct causal or cognitive relations, and that we are dealing with psychological continuity if overlapping layers of psychological connections are appealed to (cf. Parfit 1984).

One of the main problems a psychological approach faces is overcoming an alleged circularity associated with explicating personal identity relations in terms of psychological notions. Consider memory as an example. It seems that if John remembers having repaired the bike, then it is necessarily the case that John repaired the bike: saying that a person remembers having carried out an action which the person did not in fact carry out may be regarded as a misapplication of the verb “to remember.” To be sure, one can remember that an action was carried out by somebody else; it seems to be a matter of necessity, however, that one can only have first-person memories of experiences one had or actions one carried out. Consequently, the objection goes, if memory and other psychological predicates are not impartial with regards to identity judgments, a theory that involves these predicates and that at the same time proposes to explicate such identity judgments is straightforwardly circular: it plainly assumes what it intends to prove.

To make things clearer, consider the case of Teletransportation above: if at t₂ Y on Mars remembers having had at t₁ X’s experience on earth that the coffee is too hot, then, necessarily, X at t₁ is identical with Y at t₂. The dialectic of such thought experiments, however, requires that a description of the scenario is possible that does not presuppose the identity of the participants in question. We would wish to say that since X and Y share all psychological features, it is reasonable or intuitive to judge that X and Y are identical, and precisely not that since we describe the case as one in which there is a continuity between X’s and Y’s psychologies, X and Y are necessarily identical. If some psychological predicates presuppose personal identity in this way, an account of personal identity which constitutively appeals to such predicates is viciously circular.

In response, defenders of the psychological approach have created psychological concepts that share with our ordinary psychological predicates all features except presumptions of personal identity: for example, the concept of “quasi-memory” is exactly like ordinary memory apart from the fact that “memory” is judgmental with regards to personal identity whereas “quasi-memory” is not (cf. Shoemaker 1970). While many commentators regard the appeal to quasi-memory, and ultimately “quasi-psychology,” as sufficient to solve the circularity problem, some commentators think that personal concepts infiltrate extensionally articulated psychological concept-systems so deeply that any reductionist programme in personal identity is doomed from the start (cf. Evans 1982; McDowell 1997).

e. Reductionism (3): Physiological Approaches

Opponents of the psychological criterion typically favour a physiological approach. There are at least two of them: (i) the Bodily Criterion holds that the spatiotemporal continuity of a functioning human body constitutes personal identity (cf. Williams 1956-7; 1970; Thompson 1997); and (ii) the Somatic Criterion holds that the spatiotemporal continuity of the metabolic and other life-sustaining organs of a functioning human animal constitutes personal identity (cf. Mackie 1999; Olson 1997a; 1997b; Snowdon 1991; 1995; 1996). It is not obvious that there is a straightforward relation between them, for everything depends on how the notions of “functioning human body” and “life-sustaining organs” are understood. If these notions are understood similarly, the views are (close to) equivalent; the other extreme, even if unlikely to be held, is that the notions are understood differently, to the effect that they are incompatible (if, for example, a functioning human body and its life-sustaining organs could come apart). Physiological approaches have consequences many of us feel uncomfortable with. Consider the following thought experiment:

Body Swap

X’s brain is transplanted into Y’s body. X’s body and Y’s brain are destroyed, the resulting person is Z. Our alleged intuition: since Z shares with X all memories, character traits, and other psychological characteristics, X is identical with Z. Alleged conclusion: the Bodily and the Somatic Criteria are false (cf. Locke 1689, II.xxvii.15; Shoemaker 1963).

Defenders of bodily criterion and somatic criterion typically bite the bullet and argue that it is not the case that X and Y have swapped bodies, but that Y falsely believes to be X, and therefore that Z is identical with Y.

Since the psychological and physiological approaches are mutually exclusive and, we may suppose in the current context, as candidates for an adequate theory of personal identity jointly exhaustive, any objection against the psychological approach is equally an argument for the physiological approach. The initial implausibility of the physiological approach is due to thought experiments that traditionally permeate the personal identity debate and often favour psychological considerations. Defenders of the somatic approach, most notably Olson and Snowdon, have tried to shift the focus to real-life cases in which descriptions along physiological lines look much more promising. Consider:

Human Vegetable

X has at t₁ a motor bicycle accident. The being Y that is transported to the hospital is at t₂ in a persistent vegetative state. Our alleged intuition: X at t₁ is identical with Y at t₂. Alleged conclusion: all views which postulate psychological continuity as a necessary condition are false.

Fetus

Since a fetus does not possess the cognitive capacities necessary to satisfy the demands of the Psychological Criterion, if the latter is true, no person can be identical with a past fetus. Our alleged intuition: Each of us is identical with a past fetus. Alleged conclusion: all views which postulate psychological continuity as a necessary condition are false.

A third problem for the psychological approach is that it implies, supposedly, that we are not human animals (Ayers 1990; Snowdon 1990; Olson 1997a; 2002a). The argument is simple:

Premise 1: Psychological continuity is neither necessary nor sufficient for the persistence of a human animal.

Premise 2: The psychological approach claims that psychological continuity is necessary and/or sufficient for our persistence.

A: for reductio:The psychological approach is true.

B: from 2, A: Psychological continuity is necessary and/or sufficient for our persistence.

Premise 3: Psychological continuity cannot at the same time be (i) necessary and/or sufficient for a thing’s persistence and (ii) neither necessary nor sufficient for the same thing’s persistence.

C: from 1, B, 3: None of us is identical with a human animal.

Premise 2 is implied by the psychological approach. The thought experiments that support premise 1 have already been given: since the human animal each of us is has been a fetus and could end up as a human vegetable, the thought experiments Fetus and Human Vegetable above demonstrate that psychological continuity is not necessary for human animal identity. A variant of Body Swap shows that psychological continuity is not sufficient for human animal identity. Suppose X’s brain to be transplanted into Y’s skull and X’s body and Y’s brain are destroyed. Suppose further that the resulting being Z is psychologically continuous with X. In this case, it does not seem to be the case that the surgeons transplant the human animal X from one head to another. Rather, it seems, the human animal Y receives a new organ, namely a brain. Consequently, psychological continuity is not sufficient for human animal identity and premise 1 holds. Premise 3 seems to be obvious, because its being false would entail that one and the same being can outlive itself, which is absurd. The defender of the physiological approach now argues that

Premise 4: We are human animals.

C: from B, 4: The psychological approach is false.

Premise 5: Physiological and psychological answers to the persistence question are mutually exclusive and jointly exhaustive.

Conclusion: The physiological approach is true.

It may be argued that premise 4 is not a matter of metaphysics but of biological classification. The underlying problem, however, is that it seems undeniable that there is a human animal located where each of us is. If this human animal has persistence conditions different from those that determine our persistence, then there must be two things wherever each of us is located. This conclusion raises important questions and problems a psychological approach must address.

3. The Paradox of Personal Identity

One of the most influential thought experiments in recent personal identity theory is the case of fission.

a. Fission

Fission

X’s brain is removed from X’s body and X’s body is destroyed. X’s brain’s corpus callosum, the bundle of fibres responsible for retaining the capacity of information-transfer between the two brain hemispheres, is severed, leaving two (potentially) equipollent brain hemispheres. The single lower brain is divided and each hemisphere is transplanted into one of two qualitatively identical bodies of the fission outcomes Y₁ and Y₂. Our alleged intuition: since both Y₁ and Y₂ share with X all psychological characteristics, both are candidates for being identical with X: either, in the absence of the other, would have been identical with X. Alleged conclusion: either, on pain of violating the transitivity of identity, the Psychological Criterion is false or the question of whether two person-stages X at t₁ and Y₁ at t₂ are temporal parts of the same person depends on facts concerning not only X and Y₁ but also, in this case, Y₂. In the latter case, a “closest continuer” clause and/or a “no-branching” proviso must complement a psychological continuity analysis (For a development of this case, see Nozick 1981; Parfit 1984; and Wiggins 1967).

Fission scenarios emphasise the difficulty of deciding whether a thought experiment is acceptable or not. They assume the possibility of commissurotomy or brain bisection, that is, the perforation of the corpus callosum, and hemispherectomy, that is, the surgical removal of the cerebral cortex of one brain hemisphere. Commissurotomy was used in epilepsy treatment in the 50’s (cf. Nagel 1971) and hemispherectomies too have been performed in the past. However, fission cases additionally assume the possibility, in some sense or other, of dividing the subcortical regions, and in particular the single lower brain. This is not physically possible without damaging the upper brain functions (cf. Parfit 1984). Many commentators regard fission to be an acceptable challenge to theories of personal identity. Wilkes disagrees: she thinks that our ignorance about what actually happens in these cases jeopardises the theoretical relevance of fission scenarios (cf. 1988). The question of whether or not physically impossible but logically possible scenarios are acceptable remains to be answered.

Should fission be an acceptable scenario, it presents problems for the the psychological approach in particular. The fission outcomes Y₁ and Y₂ are both psychologically continuous with X. According to the psychological approach, therefore, they are both identical with X. By congruence, however, they are not identical with each other: Y₁ and Y₂ share many properties, but even at the very time the fission operation is completed differ with regards to others, such as spatio-temporal location. Consequently, fission cases seem to show that the psychological approach entails that a thing could be identical with two non-identical things, which of course violates the transitivity of identity. Some commentators have attempted to save the psychological approach by appeal to the so-called “multiple occupancy view,” that is, the claim that, despite appearances, X was two people, namely Y₁ and Y₂, all along (cf. Lewis 1976; Noonan 1989; Perry 1972). Combined with a four-dimensionalist or temporal part ontology, this view is not as absurd as it initially seems, but it is certainly controversial.

Others have acknowledged, as a consequence of fission scenarios, that psychological continuity is not sufficient for personal identity. These commentators typically complement their psychological theory with a non-branching proviso and/or a closest continuer clause. The former states that even though X would survive as Y₁ or Y₂ if the other did not exist, given that the other does exist, X ceases to exist. This proviso avoids the problem of violating the transitivity of identity. It is hard to believe, however, because it entails that I can kill you without you ever noticing: if I knock you unconscious, transplant one of your brain hemispheres into a different body, and drop you off at home before you wake up, then, if the transplant is successful and the psychological approach with non-branching proviso is true, you are dead. We could avoid this problem by adding a closest-continuer or best candidate clause, stating roughly that the best candidate for survival in a fission scenario, that is, the fission outcome which bears the most or the most important resemblances to the original person X, is identical with X. One of the problems with this suggestion is that it assumes that personal identity is an extrinsic relation. It thereby violates another important principle, namely the so-called “only X and Y rule,” which states, roughly, that if two person-stages at different times are stages of one and the same person, that will be true only in virtue of the intrinsic relation between these two stages (cf. Noonan 1989; Wiggins 2001). While this principle is not necessarily sacrosanct, it is desirable to avoid violating it.

b. The Paradox

The upshot of the preceding discussion is that we find ourselves in a perplexing situation. Let the underlying assumption be that there is a criterion of personal identity. The starting point of the debate has been that

Premise 1: A criterion of personal identity captures all those aspects of our existence that are necessary and sufficient for our persistence.

Premise 2: Our persistence is determinate.

A: from 1, 2: A criterion of personal identity determines for every possible past event e₀ and future event e₂, within the boundaries of an adequate delineation of the modality in question, whether a person X at t₁ is identical with the being that has participated in e₀ and the being that will participated in e₂.

Premise 3: Personal identity relations are factual: criteria of personal identity are determined neither by conventions, norms, or other social or personal preferences, however basic, nor by analytic matters about the meaning of concepts. Their truth is, literally, a matter of life and death.

B: from A, 3: There is a factual relation R between a person X at t₁ and a being Y at t₀/t₂ which, for every possible scenario, determines whether X at t₁ is identical with Y at t₀/t₂.

Now, if we agree with the tentative conclusion that there is, at present, no satisfactory simple view of personal identity, then we assent to the claims that

Premise 4: IM and WR–INI are, with respect to a specification of the necessary and sufficient conditions for personal identity, inadequate.

Premise 5: The distinction between IM and WR–INI on the one hand and the reductionist views sketched in I.A.4 on the other is exclusive.

C: from 4, 5: The only feasible candidates for R are relations of physiological and/or psychological continuity.

Since B demands that R holds for every possible scenario, within the limits of an adequate delineation of the modality in question, a criterion of personal identity must deliver compatible judgments on the thought experiments sketched above. However, since these thought experiments deliver conflicting intuitions about which criterion is true, it cannot be the case that more than one such criterion is true. From this it follows that

Premise 6: Physiological and psychological criteria of personal identity are incompatible, that is, R cannot be a conjunction of physiological and psychological relations as well as issuing in determinate and compatible solutions to each thought experiment.

Now, if we are also prepared to accept the

Big Assumption: A criterion of identity must accept all alleged conclusions of the thought experiments sketched in I.A.5

then we must conclude that

D: from B, 6A: Neither physiological nor psychological continuity is both necessary and sufficient for personal identity.

The problem with D is that, in conjunction with premises 2, 4, and 5, it reduces the underlying assumption that there can be an informative criterion of personal identity ad absurdum. This argument may be referred to as the Paradox of Personal Identity.

One should refrain from drawing precipitate conclusions from its defining characteristic as a paradox, that is, the fact that denying any of its premises leads to a conclusion that either violates our intuitions or, in the case of 4, 5, and C, commits one to a philosophically disreputable stance. Rather, the Paradox should be regarded as the starting point of any discussion of personal identity, in the sense that taking a stand on its individual premises bestows the various criteria of personal identity with their distinctive features. However, given that the paradox obliges us, in one way or other, to revise our pre-philosophical beliefs, a theory of personal identity should aim at meeting what will be referred to as the Adequacy Constraint AC on theories of personal identity, which demands that

AC: We ought to sanction a substantial revision of our pre-philosophical views of our metaphysical nature only on the conditions that (i) we receive an explanation of the unreliability of our intuiting faculties that in this domain outweighs our grounds for, and in other domains is compatible with, believing in their reliability; (ii) we receive an approximate demarcation of the extents to which we have to abandon our pre-philosophical beliefs and to which we can and we cannot have knowledge about ourselves.

How is the Paradox to be resolved? A, B, C, and D are deductions, and premise 1 is plausible on independent grounds. If identity is determinate, then premise 1 is true. Consequently, those arguments that deny the possibility of vague objects and indeterminate identity, in addition to our intuition that our own identity must be determinate, work in favor of 1. Note that, should personal identity be indeterminate, we might still be able to give a criterion of personal identity, even though such a criterion would then fall short of giving full necessary and sufficient conditions, since in some imaginary case it does not apply.

The denial of premise 3 seems to entail that we have, in a deep sense, an influence on whether we survive a given adventure, namely by possessing a particular normative, experiential, or attitudinal background. This contention may contradict our intuitions more than any thought experiment could. Since we assumed premises 4 and 5, only premises 2 and 6 and the Big Assumption remain. Could one deny premise 6? Given that the determinacy and factuality premises are accepted, It is hard to believe that we could: if a hybrid view were determinately true, a human being could die twice, once when her psychological and once when her physiological capacities cease to function. As a result, most commentators accept 6 but choose to accept a particular criterion in the vicinity of either side of the psychology-physiology divide. This implies that the Big Assumption must either not entail D or be rejected, which can be argued, always assuming that AC is being met, in three ways:

(a) One could define “adequacy of modality” in such a way as to exclude precisely those thought experiments which are problematic for a given criterion. There are two problems with this proposal: first, it is difficult to see how such a definition of adequacy of modality could not be ad hoc. And secondly, the suggestion is insufficient, for some thought experiments circumscribing physically possible scenarios, such as Human Vegetable, trigger incompatible intuitions as well. While some commentators think that Y is identical with X despite X’s loss of cognitive capacities, others regard Y as a living grave stone, nurtured merely for sentimental reasons, in commemoration of the deceased X.

(b) One could deny premise 2 instead, arguing that if personal identity is indeterminate, then our preferred criterion of personal identity does not have to deliver verdicts in all thought-experimental scenarios. This move has the further benefit that we do not have to quarrel with the alleged conclusion of another thought experiment, the combined spectrum:

Combined Spectrum

A spectrum of possible cases is imagined: at the near end, the normal case, X at t₁ is fully psychologically and physiologically continuous with Y at t₂, while at the far end X at t₁ is neither psychologically nor physiologically continuous with Y at t₂. In the intermediate cases, X at t₁ is approximately halfway psychologically and physiologically continuous with Y at t2. Our alleged intuition: towards the near end of the spectrum X at t₁ is identical with Y at t₂ and towards the far end of the spectrum X at t₁ is not identical with Y at t₂. There could not even in principle be evidence for the existence of a sharp borderline between the cases in which X at t₁is and the cases in which X at t₁is not identical with Y at t₂. Hence, it is implausible to believe that such a borderline exists. Alleged conclusion: personal identity is indeterminate.

Epistemicists like Timothy Williamson (cf. 1994) deny that we should render it implausible that there is such a sharp borderline merely because we are necessarily ignorant of its existence. Vagueness, according to epistemicism, consists precisely in our necessary ignorance of such sharp boundaries. The other problem is that even if personal identity is indeterminate, the claim cannot by itself establish one criterion over others: in order to do so, it would have to exclude those thought experiments that challenge opposing criteria while leaving untouched those that supposedly establish the preferred criterion. It is doubtful, however, that the indeterminacy of personal identity can be exploited selectively, for physiological and psychological continuity relations are equally indeterminate in a particular range of cases (cf. Parfit 1984). Furthermore, in those cases in which they are not, for example Body Swap, Human Vegetable, and Fetus, appeal to indeterminacy does little to remove the contradictory intuitions that these cases trigger. Consequently, unless one holds that personal identity is categorically indeterminate whenever the physiological and psychological features of a human being come apart, appeal to indeterminacy cannot establish the rejection of the Big Assumption in such a way as to avoid the Paradox’s conclusion.

(c) The most common strategy is to bite the bullet and some or other allegedly absurd conclusion of the thought experiments. The defender of the Psychological Criterion must hold that we are not identical with a past fetus or infant, and that we will not have survived if fallen into a persistent vegetative state. Defenders of a Physiological Criterion, on the other hand, must commit to the consequence that if X’s head is grafted onto Y’s body, then the resulting person is Y and not X, even though this person shares all psychological features with X before the operation.

The problem with this strategy is that, if accepted, we seem to be unable to decide on a criterion of personal identity on the basis of intuitions at all, on pain of unjustifiably favoring one’s own over other people’s intuitions. On the assumption that we are unable to hierarchically structure these conflicting intuitions, we have a classical stand-off: there are two sides to the coin of personal identity and appeal to intuition plainly underdetermines preferring one side over the other. The problem is that human beings are organic material objects, the persistence of which is determined by these objects’ following a continuous trajectory between space-time points. The further question of whether or not human beings are essentially organic material objects depends on the question of whether psychological properties render human beings to be sufficiently dissimilar from such objects so as to “deserve” their own identity criterion. The fear underlying the Paradox of Personal Identity, then, is that there may be no metaphysical fact to the matter as to whether the antecedently specifiable differences between human beings and other organic or inorganic material objects count as sufficient in order for us to have persistence conditions different from these objects. It does not seem as if any possible thought experiment, irrespectively of how unequivocal our intuitions about it, could redeem this fear. Personal identity theorists, therefore, ought to offer a more comprehensive account of the ontological status of persons and their relation to the constituents that make them up.

4. Parfit and the Unimportance of Personal Identity

Derek Parfit proposes a theory of the ontological status of persons, which promises to answer the problem of fission and the paradox of personal identity. While this article cannot do justice to the complexities of Parfit’s theory, which has been the focal point of debate since 1970, it is worth mentioning its main features.

Although Parfit affirms the existence of persons, their special ontological status as non-separately-existing substances can be expressed by the claim that persons do not have to be listed separately on an inventory of what exists. In particular, persons themselves are distinct from their bodies and psychologies, but the existence of a person consists in nothing over and above the existence of a brain and body and the occurrence of an interrelated series of mental and physical events. These are the foundational claims of Parfit’s constitutive reductionism. Consider an analogy: Cellini’s Venus is made of bronze. Although the lump of bronze and the statue itself surely exist, these objects have different persistence conditions: if melted down, Venus ceases to exist while the lump of bronze does not. Therefore, they are not identical; rather, so the suggestion, the lump of bronze constitutes the statue. The same is true of persons, who are constituted by, but not identical with, a physiology, a psychology, and the occurrence of an interrelated series of causal and cognitive relations.

Now, how does this relate to the fission case? We must first note that Parfit believes (i) that our persistence consists in physical and/or psychological continuity; (ii) that personal identity is indeterminate in some cases, that is, that sometimes there is no right-or-wrong answer to the question of whether somebody has ceased to exist in the course of a certain adventure (see 3.b.); (iii) that what prudentially matters in survival is psychological continuity; (iv) that personal identity relations must respect the remaining formal properties of identity. This means that in the fission case Y₁ and Y₂ cannot be identical with X because the transitivity of identity is violated: therefore, X dies in the fission case. It further means, however, that X has two Parfitian survivors, Y₁ and Y₂, which is, according to Parfit, as good (or even better) than being identical with Y₁ and/or Y₂. This is the upshot of Parfit’s claim that what prudentially matters is psychological continuity: for all we should care, from a purely rational point of view, it is good enough for us to be psychologically continuous with one or more future persons and consequently it would be irrational for us to prefer our own continued existence to death by fission. Generally, according to Parfit, psychological continuity with any reliable cause matters in survival, and since personal identity does not consist merely in psychological continuity with any reliable cause, personal identity is not what matters in survival.

5. References and Further Reading

ANTHOLOGIES

Bermúdez, Jos‚ Luis; Marcel, Anthony & Eilan, Naomi eds. (1995), The Body and the Self (Cambridge, MA & London: The MIT Press)
Blakemore, Colin & Greenfield, Susan eds. (1987), Mindwaves (Oxford: Blackwell)
Charles, David & Lennon, Kathleen eds. (1992), Reduction, Explanation, and Realism (Oxford: Clarendon)
Cockburn, David ed. (1991), Human Beings, Royal Institute of Philosophy Supplement, Vol. 29 (Cambridge University Press)
Dancy, Jonathan ed. (1997), Reading Parfit (Oxford: Blackwell)
Davies, Martin & Stone, Tony eds. (1995), Folk Psychology: The Theory of Mind Debate (Oxford: Blackwell)
Harris, Henry ed. (1995), Identity (Oxford: Clarendon)
Lovibond, Sabina & Williams, Stephen G. eds. (1996), Essays for David Wiggins: Identity, Truth, and Value (Oxford: Blackwell)
Macdonald, Graham F. ed. (1979), Perception and Identity: Essays Presented to A. J. Ayer, with His Replies (Ithaca, New York: Cornell University Press)
Martin, Raymond & Barresi, John eds. (2003), Personal Identity (Oxford: Blackwell)
Perry, John ed. (1975), Personal Identity (Berkeley & Los Angeles, CA: University of California Press)
Rorty, Amelie O. ed. (1976), The Identities of Persons (Berkeley & Los Angeles, CA: University of California Press)

BOOKS AND ARTICLES

Ayers, Michael (1991), Locke: Epistemology and Ontology, 2 vols. (London & New York: Routledge)
Baker, Lynne Rudder (1997), “Why Constitution Is Not Identity,” The Journal of Philosophy, Vol. 94, No. 12, 599-621
Baillie, James (1993), “Recent Work on Personal Identity,” Philosophical Books, Vol. 34, No. 4, 193-206
Behrendt, Kathy (2003), “The New Neo-Kantian and Reductionist Debate,” Pacific Philosophical Quarterly Vol. 84, No. 4, 331-50
Blackburn, Simon W. (1984), “Has Kant Refuted Parfit?,” in Dancy ed. (1997), pp. 180-201
Butler, Joseph (1736), “Of Personal Identity,” First Dissertation to The Analogy of Religion (reprinted in Perry ed. (1975), pp. 99-105)
Campbell, John (1992), “The First Person: The Reductionist View of the Self,” in Charles & Lennon eds. (1992), pp. 381-419
Cassam, Quassim (1989), “Kant and Reductionism,” Review of Metaphysics, Vol. 43, No. 1, 72-106
Cassam, Quassim (1992), “Reductionism and First-Person Thinking,” in Charles & Lennon eds. (1992), pp. 361-80
Cassam, Quassim (1993), “Parfit on Persons,” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, Vol. 93, 17-37
Cassam, Quassim (1997), Self and World (Oxford University Press)
Chisholm, Roderick M. (1976), Person and Object (Chicago & La Salle, IL: Open Court)
Crane, Tim (2001), Elements of Mind (Oxford University Press)
Doepke, Frederick C. (1996), The Kinds of Things: A Theory of Personal Identity Based on Transcendental Argument (Chicago & La Salle, IL: Open Court)
Evans, Gareth M. (1982), The Varieties of Reference, ed. John McDowell (New York: Oxford University Press)
Evans, Gareth M. (1985), Collected Papers, ed. Antonia Phillips (Oxford: Clarendon)
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Garrett, Brian (1995), “Wittgenstein and the First Person,” Australasian Journal of Philosophy, Vol. 73, No. 3, 347-55
Garrett, Brian (1998), Personal Identity and Self-Consciousness (London: Routledge)
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Hume, David (1739), A Treatise on Human Nature, ed. Norton, David F. & Norton, Mary J. (Oxford University Press)
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Johnston, Mark (1997), “Human Concerns Without Superlative Selves,” in Dancy ed. (1997), pp. 149-79
Locke, John (1689), An Essay Concerning Human Understanding, ed. Woolhouse, Roger (London: Penguin, 1997)
Lowe, E. Jonathan (1991), “Real Selves: Persons as Substantial Kinds,” in Cockburn ed. (1991), pp. 87-108
Lowe, E. Jonathan (1996), Subjects of Experience (Cambridge University Press)
Martin, Raymond (1998), Self-Concern: An Experiential Approach to What Matters in Survival (Cambridge University Press)
McDowell, John (1997), “Reductionism and the First Person,” in Dancy ed. (1997), pp. 230-50
Merricks, Trenton (1998), “There Are No Criteria of Identity Over Time,” No–s, Vol. 32, No.1, 106-124
Moore, Adrian W. (1997), Points of View (Oxford: Clarendon)
Nagel, Thomas (1971), “Brain Bisection and the Unity of Consciousness,” Synthese, Vol. 22, 396-413
Nagel, Thomas (1986), The View From Nowhere (Oxford: Clarendon)
Noonan, Harold W. (1989), Personal Identity (London: Routledge)
Noonan, Harold (1993), “Constitution Is Identity,” Mind, Vol. 102, No. 405, 133-46
Nozick, Robert (1981), Philosophical Explanations (Oxford: Clarendon)
Olson, Eric T. (1997a), The Human Animal: Personal Identity Without Psychology (Oxford University Press)
Olson, Eric T. (1997b), “Relativism and Persistence,” Philosophical Studies, Vol. 88, No. 2, 141-62
Parfit, Derek A. (1971a), “Personal Identity,” The Philosophical Review, Vol. 80, No. 1, 3-27
Parfit, Derek A. (1971b), On “The Importance of Self-Identity”,” The Journal of Philosophy, Vol. 68, No. 20, 683-90
Parfit, Derek A. (1976), “Lewis, Perry, and What Matters,” in Rorty ed. (1976), pp. 91-107
Parfit, Derek A. (1982), “Personal Identity and Rationality,” Synthese, Vol. 53, 227-41
Parfit, Derek A. (1984), Reasons and Persons (Oxford University Press; revised reprint, Oxford: Clarendon, 1987)
Parfit, Derek A. (1986), “Comments,” Ethics, Vol. 96, No. 4, 832-872
Parfit, Derek A. (1987), “Divided Minds and the Nature of Persons,” in Blakemore & Greenfield eds. (1987), pp. 19-26
Parfit, Derek A. (1995), “The Unimportance of Identity,” in Harris ed. (1995), pp. 13-45 (reprinted in Martin & Barresi eds. (2003), pp. 292-318)
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Author Information

Carsten Korfmacher
Email: C.Korfmacher.99 (at) cantab.net
Linacre College, Oxford University
United Kingdom

Supervenience and Determination

The term “supervenience” gained prominence in the twentieth century when it was suggested that moral properties supervene on natural properties and that our mental characteristics supervene on our physical characteristics such as the properties of our nervous system. The term can be defined as follows. For two sets of properties, A (the supervenient set) and B (the subvenient set or supervenience base), A supervenes on B just in case there can be no difference in A without a difference in B. Turning this principle on its head gives us the converse concept of determination: B determines A just in case sameness with respect to B implies sameness with respect to A. Supervenience and determination are simply two sides of the same coin.

From the basic definition initially presented, supervenience might seem a fairly innocuous principle, yet it has led a somewhat murky and controversial existence: some love it; some hate it. It was, for example, described by John Post as an “accordion word: indefinitely stretchable” (1984, p. 163). It has certainly been pulled about throughout its history, but it does have its limits. Indeed, others view it as too limited to be of any philosophical worth whatsoever. This article charts the history of the concept of supervenience, discusses the current panoply of definitions, and reviews some of the more tractable portions of the contemporary debate. The primary aim is to gain a feel for the basic concept without getting bogged down with the more formal and abstruse aspects of supervenience. The aim of this first section is to get to grips with the core idea of supervenience, and see some of the contexts in which it has been and might be used.

Getting to Grips with Supervenience
The Recent History of Supervenience
The Unlovely Proliferation of Formulations
Supervenience and Causation
Reduction, Emergence, and Multiple Realization
Adding Mystery to Mystery?
References and Further Reading

1. Getting to Grips with Supervenience

As David Lewis puts it, “We have supervenience when there could be no difference of one sort without differences of another sort” (1986, p. 14). For example: no difference in an individual’s mental characteristics without some difference in physical characteristics; no difference in a computer’s program without a difference in the computer’s circuitry; no difference in the economy without some difference in the behavior of its underlying economic agents; no difference in the temperature of a gas without some difference in the behavior of the molecules forming it, and so on. But notice that there can be differences in the neurons, circuitry, agents, and molecules without a difference in mental, computational, economic, and thermal properties.

The idea in each of the above cases is that some property A (or family of properties) is “determined” by some other properties B that do not themselves possess the property A, and that do not reduce to B (though this is a controversial point, as we shall see): individual neurons don’t possess mental characteristics; circuits don’t possess computational properties; individual agents don’t possess economic properties; and individual molecules don’t have temperatures. The intent is to avoid the stronger relations (such as identity or definability) between the types of property, generally because it often isn’t clear how there could be such strong relations holding them together. Part of the reason for this, and one prime motivation for supervenience, is that mental, computational, economic, and thermodynamic characteristics are “multiply realizable:: the same properties might be realized by very different underlying physical configurations or stuff. However, it needs to be strong enough to support a kind of non-symmetric dependence between two levels of property, such that a “lower” level determines a “higher” level. This feature may give rise to the notion of “levels of dependence” and, in certain cases, “hierarchical organization”: the mental is at a higher “level,” is higher up the hierarchy, from the physical; the economy is at a higher level than the economic agents, and so on.

This hierarchy of levels charts out a progression of ontological dependence too: without the physical stuff of neurons, circuits, people, and molecules (or something like them), the higher level states would not exist at all. This feature thus makes supervenience a useful tool in analyzing relations between the subject matter of distinct theoretical disciplines, such as the relation between physics and biology. It is, more generally useful in analyzing relations between things that are connected (correlated) in a way that doesn’t suggest reduction or identity. However, note that levels are not a generic feature of supervenience. Consider the case of the relationship between the length of the sides of a square and the area of the square. There is, in both directions, no difference in one without a difference in the other, and once the sides (respectively, area) are fixed the area (respectively, length) is fixed. So we have a clear case of supervenience. But this is a symmetric case, and so the notion of a level of dependence or hierarchy makes no sense; it only makes sense when the relation is asymmetric, and these make for the most philosophically interesting cases.

But, before we get bogged down with such details, what is the basic idea of supervenience? It is perhaps best understood by means of a colorful example. To this end, let us begin by adapting a simple story presented by Paul Teller (1983). Teller asks us to imagine a bunch of watches churned out of an assembly line in the same state, so that they are functionally and qualitatively (at least, in terms of their intrinsic properties) identical—clearly the watches will register the same time. The properties having to do with the physical makeup of the watches—their structure and composition, and so on—give us our B set of properties (the subvenient set). The supervenient A set has to do with the time-keeping properties of the watches—for example, whether they enable their owners to get into work on time, and so on. In this case, as Teller points out, the A properties of some particular watch will be the same as any other watch from the assembly line since they have the same physical makeup (B properties), and that is all that counts towards the A properties in this story. Being a good timekeeper supervenes on the physical makeup of the timekeeping device: one could not alter the time-keeping properties of the watches without altering their underlying structural and compositional properties. Moreover, any two devices that share their physical makeup will either both be good or both be bad timekeepers. That is to say, the physical make-up of a watch determines its time-keeping properties.

Though this captures much of the basic idea as encapsulated in our opening definition (which we can abbreviate to “no A-difference without a B-difference”), it misses one very crucial detail: modal impact. Supervenience is not intended to be a contingent “matter of actual fact” claim concerning two sets of properties that happen to be correlated at some particular time or place. Rather, it is intended to cover any situation involving A and B, covering any time, place, and world—though there will be natural restrictions concerning which worlds are to be included here (for example, logically possible [so that all logically coherent, non-contradictory worlds are considered], nomologically possible [so that all worlds permitted by the laws of physics are considered], and metaphysically possible [considering a class of worlds somewhere between the logically possible and the nomologically possible ones]). Different restrictions give different strengths. In our example, we should have to extend our story to include all possible watches that are indistinguishable in terms of their B-properties, including those inhabiting distinct worlds (from alien worlds and Twin-Earths, perhaps to worlds with different laws of physics). This additional modal aspect results in a profusion of distinct formulations that aim to adequately capture the fundamental notion of supervenience. Further proliferation results from the question of what are to be the objects that have the properties that enter into the supervenience/determination relation. Supervenience is, then, clearly far from innocuous!

2. The Recent History of Supervenience

Jaegwon Kim (1993, p. 131) notes that the term “supervenience” was in currency as far back as 1594. In its vernacular sense it means to “[come upon] a given event as something additional and extraneous (perhaps as something unexpected)” (ibid, p.132). However, the concept of Supervenience, as a philosophical term of art, is generally acknowledged to be traceable to G.E. Moore’s work on value theory, and from thence to R.M. Hare’s work on meta-ethics in which the term ‘supervenience’ was introduced into the philosophical literature. There it stifled for some time, before being unearthed by Davidson who applied it to the ‘mental-physical’ relationship. Let us review some central points from this historical development.

In “The Conception of Intrinsic Value” Moore writes that:

…if a given thing possesses any kind of intrinsic value in a certain degree, then not only must that same thing possess it, under all circumstances, in the same degree, but also anything exactly like it, must, under all circumstances, possess it in exactly the same degree. … it is not possible that of two exactly similar things one should possess it and the other not, or that one should possess it in one degree, and the other in a different one.

(Moore 1922, p. 261)

This sentiment is virtually parroted by Hare, this time specifically utilizing the term “supervenience” to describe the relation between certain natural (non-moral, physical) and moral properties, giving us ‘moral supervenience’:

…let us take that characteristic of “good” which has been called its supervenience. Suppose that we say ‘St. Francis was a good man.’ It is logically impossible to say this and to maintain at the same time that there might have been another man placed exactly in the same circumstances as St. Francis, and who behaved in exactly the same way, but who differed from St. Francis in this respect only, that he was not a good man.

(Hare 1952, p. 145)

Before we continue with the historical matters, let us briefly pause to consider what this means. Again, let’s give a simple example. Imagine we draw up a pair of catalogues of the properties of two people Saint Francis and Faint Srancis. The properties of Saint Francis are, say, kindness, bravery, niceness, neighborliness, and goodness. Faint Srancis’ properties differ from Saint Francis only in that the last property, goodness, is missing from his catalogue. Suppose, instead, that he has the property “badness” in its place. Now, according to the moral supervenience thesis espoused by Hare, this is simply not a genuinely possible state of affairs. All of the other properties, minus goodness, serve to fix or determine the property of goodness. It is just not possible that there be two such individuals differing in this way (whether they occupy the same world or not). Therefore, in possessing all of Saint Francis’ properties up to, but not including goodness, Faint Srancis must also thereby possess the property of goodness too. This is what is meant in saying that the property of goodness supervenes on a family of natural properties not including goodness. (Note that this matches Stalnaker’s, 1996, p. 87, preferred definition of supervenience: “To say that the A-properties or facts are supervenient on the B-properties or facts is to say that the A-facts are, in a sense, redundant, since they are already implicitly specified when one has specified all the B-facts.”) Let us now return to the historical path of the concept.

As Kim and others have pointed out, it seems that both some version of the concept and the term ‘supervenience’ were in operation before Moore’s and Hare’s usage in the context of the British Emergentist School. The emergentist’s understanding of supervenience, being more in line with the vernacular sense, does not match the current understanding as well as Moore’s and Hare’s. See McLaughlin 1992 for an excellent analysis. Indeed, supervenience, as a concept, most likely has much earlier roots than this, and one can readily find examples (or approximations, at least) littered throughout the history of philosophy. Leibniz’s theory of space and time might be one such example, with spatial and temporal properties supervenient on non-spatial and non-temporal events. Hume’s theory of causation might be another example, with cause and effect supervening on sequences of events that do not have causal properties. However, for the purposes of a cleaner exposition we will stick with the orthodox historical trajectory of supervenience. Not many philosophers initially picked up on Hare’s use of supervenience, but new life was breathed into it when Donald Davidson (1970) utilized it to provide some of the support for his anomalous monism. For example, in an oft-quoted passage he writes:

Although the position I describe denies there are psychophysical laws, it is consistent with the view that mental characteristics are in some sense dependent, or supervenient, on physical characteristics. Such supervenience might be taken to mean that there cannot be two events alike in all physical respects but differing in some mental respect, or that an object cannot alter in some mental respect without altering in some physical respect.

(Davidson 1970, p.214)

Davidson uses this supervenience relation to defend a non-reductive, but nonetheless non-dualist, position with regard to the way in which the mental stands to the physical (that is, psychophysical supervenience). Though the mental is certainly dependent upon the physical, in the sense that the physical determines the mental, it cannot be reduced to it since there are no psychophysical laws while there are, of course, physical laws:

[P]sychological characteristics cannot be reduced to the others, nevertheless they may be (and I think are) strongly dependent on them. Indeed, there is a sense in which the physical characteristics of an event (or object or state) determine the psychological characteristics…

(Davidson 1973, p. 716)

Once it entered the mainstream literature via Davidson, other philosophers (Jaegwon Kim in particular) began to focus on supervenience as an object of study in its own right—the 1984 Spindel conference saw the beginnings of much of this new direction (see Horgan (ed.), 1984—required reading for those wishing to gain a deeper appreciation of the foundations of supervenience). This trend shows no signs of letting up, though there is certainly some increased negativity about the concept’s usefulness and significance. A large part of the perceived problem with supervenience is that there is no unique, agreed-upon formulation of it. Instead there are many distinct formulations. However, this might not be such a bad thing; different jobs may require different tools. It is entirely possible that the fortunes of supervenience will reverse with the coming of age of the so-called “science of complexity,” for this involves direct consideration of the relationship between levels in hierarchies whereby a higher level is generated by the level below—it also involves many of the “special sciences.” Supervenience might thus provide the required conceptual framework to make sense of this feature of complex systems. It has, for example, been endorsed by Elliot Sober (1993) as the best way of understanding the biological concept of “fitness,” the idea being that fitness is something exhibited by very different species and individuals in relation to very different environments.

3. The Unlovely Proliferation of Formulations

We come now to the “embarrassment of riches” issue concerning the formulation of supervenience—the problem of there appearing to be too many possible formulations. David Lewis refers to this as an “unlovely proliferation” (1986, p.14). The proliferation arises simply in trying to pin down what is meant by supervenience in a precise way. The core idea that a formulation needs to capture is that fixing some one set of properties fixes some other property (or properties). The first distinction we meet is that between weak and strong supervenience. These can be stated simply enough in plain English as follows:

[Weak-SV]: For any possible world w, B-duplicates in w are A-duplicates in w.

[Strong-SV]: For any possible worlds w and w*, B-duplicates (x and y) in w and w* respectively are A-duplicates in w and w* respectively.

So, for example, according to Weak-SV, if we (perhaps here on our ‘plain vanilla’ Earth) managed to create a Star-Trek style replication machine and proceeded to replicate the physical makeup of a person P, generating a copy P_rep, then P and P_rep would share their mental characteristics too: “same worldly” physical duplicates are also mental duplicates. To understand Strong-SV we simply imagine that some Twin-Earthlings (in another possible world) got hold of an exact blueprint of P and are sufficiently advanced to be able to create a physical replica. Once again P and P_rep are mental duplicates since they are physical duplicates. (By simply setting w = w*, and assuming the same types of worlds, we see that Strong-SV implies Weak-SV, but not vice versa.)

The difference between Weak and Strong supervenience, then, simply boils down to their respective modal strengths. One world is quantified over in the former, with objects compared within a world, while all worlds (subject to some restriction) are quantified over in the latter, with objects compared across worlds. For this reason Jackson (1998, p. 9) refers to these types as “intra-world” and “inter-world” supervenience respectively. Clearly the weak formulation cannot support basic counterfactuals of the form “if there were some B-duplicate of some object, then it would be an A-duplicate too.” Without this ability, Weak-SV is pretty much useless, for some dependency might be purely accidental. For example, it is perfectly consistent with Weak-SV that there be a world physically identical to ours yet with no conscious beings. (Though, of course, if one wants to describe such possibly accidental relations then Weak-SV might indeed be the right tool for the job.) Note also that Weak-SV does not tell us that a certain group of B-properties makes one morally good, or a piece beautiful, or a piece of matter alive. All Weak-SV tells us is that B-twins are A-twins; it does not tell us whether B-twins are one way or the other morally speaking, for example, just that whatever goes for on goes for the other. Hence, it fails to accomplish the task we set it: namely, to encode a notion of dependence and determination. Strong-SV gets around this problem of course, but it has its own problems. Suppose that there are two individuals, Fred and Ted, inhabiting worlds w and w* respectively. Let Fred and Ted be “almost” B-duplicates, differing only in one single trivial B-property, suppose one is wearing aftershave and the other is not. Then it follows from Strong-SV that Fred could be conscious but Ted not, all because he didn’t remember to put aftershave on!

There are alternative “modal operator” [MO] versions of the weak and strong formulations of supervenience. Again in “plain” English, these are:

[MO-Weak-SV]: Necessarily, if anything has property F in A, then there is some property G in B such that the thing has G, and whatever has G has F.

[MO-Strong-SV]: Necessarily, if anything has property F in A, then there is some property G in B such that the thing has G, and necessarily whatever has G has F.

The only difference between strong and weak here is that the strong formulation features an additional necessity operator. What these definitions amount to is this: Weak supervenience holds at any world (given restrictions on the class of worlds), and once that world is selected one compares B-duplicates, in that world, and sees whether they are A-duplicates, if weak supervenience is true then they will be. Strong supervenience holds at any world (again, given restrictions on the allowable worlds), and once a world is selected it follows that at any world accessible from that world, objects in the initially selected and the accessed world that are B-duplicates, will be A-duplicates—hence, one can compare cross-world cases. The modal operator versions capture something that the possible worlds formulations miss, namely that possession of a supervenient property demands that a subvenient one be had as well. So, in the possible worlds formulation, two things can be B-duplicates by not possessing any B-properties (that is, if they exactly zero B-properties)! Not so in the modal operator versions.

Another distinction concerns that between Weak-SV and Strong-SV, taken as a pair, and Global supervenience, which we can write as:

[Global-SV]: Possible worlds w and w* that are B-duplicates are also A-duplicates.

Thus, whereas Weak-SV and Strong-SV concern the properties of individual objects (within a world and potentially across worlds respectively), Global-SV concerns whole possible worlds and the pattern of properties distributed over them. One might wish for such a formulation to capture certain philosophical theses, such as physicalism (roughly: fixing the physical facts fixes everything), Humean supervenience (roughly: everything is fixed by the spatiotemporal distribution of local intrinsic properties), or determinism (roughly: everything to the future is fixed by the present, and perhaps past, facts), which involve worlds (or ‘world segments’) taken as individual objects. In each formulation, though, we can distinguish between cases with differing modal force by quantifying over different types of possible world (that is, by imposing different accessibility relations on the set of worlds). An accessibility relation is just a binary relation R_Mod (w, w*) holding between pairs of worlds, w and w*, so that R_Mod (w, w*) is true whenever w* satisfies the same M-laws (of physics, logic, and so forth) as w. If you’re only bothered about relations satisfying our laws of physics, then you will only want to consider the nomologically possible worlds, in which case R_Nom (w, w*) whenever w* follows the same physical laws as w. If you want to go beyond our laws, then quantification over the metaphysically possible worlds is more appropriate (one needs to ‘expand’ the accessibility relation).

There is some confusion in spelling out what is meant in saying that worlds are B-duplicates. Does it mean that the worlds may differ in other ways, so long as they do not differ with respect to B-properties? For example, might we consider two worlds B-duplicates where one world, but not the other, has ghosts (with C-properties)? If they are B-duplicates, and B-properties account for all there is, and the worlds contain the same individuals, then what distinguishes such worlds? These issues can cause problems when one tries to put supervenience to work. Moreover, Global-SV faces a similar problem to that mentioned with regard to Strong-SV. So long as two worlds are not B-duplicates they can differ in any way you like with respect to their A-properties. For example, if one single atom is out of place, then this could mean that one world has conscious beings and the other world only has zombies!

A further distinction is to be made between “single domain supervenience” and “multiple domain supervenience.” The difference here concerns whether we wish to consider the A- and B-properties associated to the same or to different things respectively. In the latter, multiple domain case, one would look at those cases where there cannot be A-differences in one thing without a B-difference in some other distinct thing. Thus, weak and strong are clearly single domain formulations. The multiple domain account has several applications: for example, in the case of the problem of material composition (for example, the way a statue stands to the lump of clay that out of which it is composed), those who believe that the statue and the clay literally coincide (share their spatial boundaries at a time, if not for all time, and indeed these divergent histories is what makes them different—they can also differ in their modal properties, so that they satisfy different counterfactuals) will want to say that the statue supervenes on the clay. But since these are two different things, according to the coincidence advocate, w will need a multiple domain account. For the same reasons, those who view societies, or other similar structures, as separate objects, autonomous from the individuals from which they are composed, will need a multiple domain account if they wish to say that social properties supervene on the properties of the underlying individuals. (One can also formulate “local” or “regional” supervenience, which restrict the supervenience relation to a spacetime region within a world, rather than some concrete object within a world. Again, this splits into weak and strong versions.)

There is something of a cottage industry devoted to spelling out the various entailment relations between the various formulations. We saw that Strong-SV implies Weak-SV, and it looks like Strong-SV implies Global-SV too. However, the converse is trickier: given a certain understanding of the properties involved, they become equivalent. However, equivalence is ruled out by a simple counterexample (due to Petrie): Suppose we have two worlds w and w*, each with two properties A = {S}| and B= {P}, and two individuals x and y (and no more) in world w, and x* and y* (and no more) in world w*. The world w is characterized by the following distribution of properties over its individuals: Px, Sx, Py, ~Sy. While world w* is characterized by the distribution: Px*, ~Sx*, ~Py*, and ~Sy*. Clearly, strong supervenience is ruled out by this model since x and x* are B-duplicates but not A-duplicates. But this isn’t incompatible with global supervenience because the worlds are not B-duplicates, so A-duplication is irrelevant. The fact that this model is consistent with global supervenience yet inconsistent with strong supervenience is enough, says Petrie, to show that they are not equivalent. There are objections to this argument, but we shan’t go in to these matters here. Let us instead turn to some controversial issues that arise in contemporary debates.

4. Supervenience and Causation

Supervenient properties are often those to which we wish to attach causal powers. For example, mental effects from mental causes and even physical effects from mental causes. If one thinks of an old love it may cause one to feel sad, or have some other emotion. It may cause one to cry. But the mental supervenes on the physical, which means that the physical fixes the mental. So both mental causes and mental effects are supervenient on some physical conditions. But then the mental cause is irrelevant here since the physical conditions are sufficient to bring about the effect. At best, the mental effect is over-determined by the mental and physical causes. At worst, it leads to epiphenomenalism about mental properties. Presumably the ground of the supervenience relation will be relevant here.

If the supervenient properties are understood as emergent, then it is possible that some “global” properties, to do with a whole system, can causally effect other things, and its parts (the supervenience base). For example, a group of agents can interact to generate an economy, but the economy has properties of its own (prices, interest rates, and such like); these will be able to influence how the agents behave. In other words, there is the possibility of a ‘feedback loop’ from global to local. Such a possibility would appear not to be available in the case of a “mereological” grounding of a supervenience relation, according to which the whole is just identified with the sum of its parts. In the former case, the whole is supposed to be some how more than the sum of its parts (due to the non-linear nature of the interactions between the parts). But, nonetheless, in both cases, once we fix the subvenient properties, we fix the supervenient ones too. However, there are very problematic causal issues involved in the case with a feedback loop where we would appear to have “downward causation” so that the supervenient properties constrain and even modify the subvenient ones. The existence of a “preferred direction” to the relation seems to have been lost in such cases. This is an interesting topic in need of much further work, but we cannot pursue it further here.

5. Reduction, Emergence, and Multiple Realization

Reductionism is as old as philosophy itself. The ancient Greek cosmologists each defended what appear to be reductive theories according to which everything that exists is made up of some single fundamental element or a group of such elements. Most apt here is the version of atomism given to us by Leuccipus and Democritus according to which all things, including secondary qualities, souls, and thoughts, were reduced to atoms moving in the void. But there are some things that, it seems, are not easily reducible. Take Beethoven’s Fifth Symphony. How does one reduce this? To a sound structure (that is, a sequence of sounds)? If so, then many different sound structures can realize it, on CDs, Vinyl, a badly tuned piano, and so on. This piece of music is, then, multiply realizable (there is a many-to-one relationship between the subvenient realizations and the supervenient property). We might also consider some “higher order” properties of musical works, say “being a grand piece of music.” This property too is multiply realizable: there are many ways to be a grand piece of music. This seems to rule out reduction, at least to a unique sound structure. But, and here we return to Hare’s example, if there are two indistinguishable realizations, then if one is a grand work of music, the other cannot fail to be. The grandeur is determined by the sound structure—we are, of course, assuming that grandeur is a property intrinsic to a work, otherwise one and the same sound structure could be both grand and not grand.

This multiple realizability lies at the core of supervenience’s job, namely, to describe a dependency weaker than identity and reduction. The idea is, that fixing the physical properties of the work of music (the tones, durations, intensities, and so on) suffices to fix any and all aesthetic properties the piece might have. But then the idea of emergence amounts to the claim that these aesthetic properties (and similar higher-level properties) are not reducible to the physical ones, they are something “novel” arising from the physical organization. (The distinction between physical and non-physical properties here amounts to both the fact that the latter type can be had by many objects with different natures and constitutions, and the fact that the former type obey the laws of, possibly complete, physics. However, nothing said here hinges on this distinction, one might as well say that aesthetic properties are physical too, since they occupy the world. Thus, this is just a way of speaking to label a curious fact, namely that some properties seem not to be reducible to what are standardly taken to be unproblematic ‘physical’ properties, such as mass, charge, spin, and so on.) Dualism and epiphenomenalism are avoided (1) because the physical facts are needed to fix the emergent facts and (2) because the emergent properties are supposed to be causally efficacious: the beauty of the Adagio from Mahler’s Fifth Symphony can cause a person to cry; it isn’t the durations, intensities, and pitch of sounds that is causally responsible—though one might conceivably take a hard line here and argue that it is precisely the physical (subvenient) properties that cause the tears. (Though it must be understood that causation is far from simple in these contexts, as we saw in the previous section.)

In an early and pioneering work on supervenience and determination, in the context of a defense and formulation of physicalism, Hellman and Thompson were concerned with separating out supervenience from reduction. Physicalism can be understood simply as follows: When God made the World, did he just have to fix the facts regarding the elementary particles and the forces (the B-properties) and all the rest (the A-properties: colors, qualia, aesthetic properties, moral properties, and so forth) followed from that, or did he have to then attach all the rest? A physicalist will answer Yes to the former question. Supervenience, or rather determination, is supposed to support the affirmative answer, for it says precisely that the B-properties determine the A-properties. Hellman and Thompson wanted to show that supervenience is neutral in respect of reduction between supervenient and subvenient levels of properties.

Why might we wish to defend the view that supervenience is non-reductive? One reason, as we have seen, is to capture a notion of ontological dependence—say of the mind on physical brain states or processes—without eliminating the mind, or identifying the mind with the brain states. The problem with such a view is that prima facie it appears to let in ‘unphysical’ properties, that either amount to dualism or epiphenomenalism. There is certainly a problem in making ontological sense of supervenient properties, but one needn’t espouse either dualism or epiphenomenalism if one is committed to a supervenience thesis. For all that is being said is that fixing some one set of facts fixes some others. However, there is an argument that attempts to demonstrate that supervenience is reductive. Let us consider this argument, and then present one against reduction.

The argument is given in Kim’s “Supervenience and Nomological Incommensurables”. In capsule form, it goes as follows: Suppose we have two sets of properties, P (for physical) and S (for special, as in special science). Let s be a property in S and let p_n be the list of properties contained in P. Define q_n to be the set of maximally conjunctive properties that can be built from p_n (where the maximally conjunctive condition means that for each p_i, either p_i or its negation is a conjunct of q_n). If S is supervenient on P then any pair of objects that share some q_i must both possess s or both lack s. Now, let D be the disjunction of all of those q_i such that if an object has qi then it has s too. However, this implies that possession of an S property is equivalent to possession of a P property. In other words, for all x’s, s has x if and only if D has x (in shorthand: x , s(x) iff D(x)). This, of course, is tantamount to a reduction of S to P, for the claim is that every higher level, supervenient, property is coextensive with some Boolean complex of lower level, subvenient, properties, say a long (possibly infinite) disjunction of properties. Thus, any two objects with the supervenient property A must possess the very same subvenient property B, but B is a very complex property that will involve an exhaustive list of the ways that A could be had by any object.

Hellmann and Thompson’s strategy is to disallow infinite conjunctions and disjunctions of properties, thereby blocking the route to the infinitely complex properties that Kim’s argument let in, and therefore blocking the route to reduction. However, while an outright ban on such properties may be otherwise well motivated, it is too ad hoc in this case. A more promising approach to stop Kim’s argument is to simply not allow that the kind of Boolean operations that Kim utilizes to generate new properties result in genuine properties. One might apply this strategy either to negations of properties, disjunctive properties, conjunctive properties, or some combination of these (see McLaughlin’s article “Varieties of Supervenience”).

In his “Reduction of Mind” Lewis speaks of supervenience as a reductive principle, going somewhat against the philosophical grain. As a build up he writes:

I hold, as an a priori principle, that every contingent truth must be made true, somehow, by the pattern of coinstantiation of fundamental properties and relations [that is, occurring all together]. The whole truth about the world, including the mental part of the world, supervenes on this pattern. If two possible worlds were exactly isomorphic in their patterns of coinstantiation of fundamental properties and relations, they would thereby be exactly alike simpliciter.

(Lewis 1994, p.292)

Lewis adds to this that all the fundamental properties and relations are physical, so that a materialist thesis is generated from the supervenience—the position amounts, more or less, to a statement of his “Humean Supervenience;” the claim that “All there is to the world is a vast mosaic of local matters of fact…And that is all” (1986, p.ix-x) so that “truth supervenes on being” (1994b, p.225). But how can supervenience be reductive? Lewis gives the following example:

Imagine a grid of a million tiny spots – pixels – each of which can be made light or dark. When some are light and some are dark, they form a picture, replete with interesting gestalt properties. The case evokes reductionist comments. Yes, the picture really does exist. Yes, it really does have those gestalt properties. However, the picture and the properties reduce to the arrangement of light and dark pixels. They are nothing over and above the pixels. They make nothing true that is not made true already by the pixels. They could go unmentioned in an inventory of what there is without thereby rendering that inventory incomplete. And so on.

(Lewis 1994, p. 294)

Such comments Lewis happily endorses: “The picture reduces to the pixels. And that is because the picture supervenes on the pixels” (loc. cit.). Lewis’ position here stems from the fact that the supervenience relation is (in this case, at least) non-symmetric and relates large to small—though it isn’t at all obvious that this is sufficient for reduction.

However, there is a way for the anti-reductionist to respond here, and this response ties in to much of the contemporary debate regarding supervenience (and emergence). The response is known as the “multiple realizability” objection, and was first used by Jerry Fodor (1974) in the context of the debate concerning the non-reducibility of special science to lower-level science (ultimately, physics). The argument, in a nutshell, is that properties associated to a ‘special science’ (for example, psychology) can be realized by a multitude of heterogeneous lower-level properties or states. Let us see how this works by focusing on a simplified example given by Putnam (1975).

We are asked to consider a board that has a round hole in it of 5 inches in diameter, and a square peg that is 5 inches on each of its sides. Clearly the peg will not go into the hole. The question we are faced with is why the peg does not go through. Obviously, says Putnam, the respective size and shape of the peg and hole give us the answer. These properties, size and shape, Putnam refers to as “macroproperties”, as contrasted with the “microproperties,” of the peg and board, namely the positions, momenta, charge, and so forth, of the atoms composing them. Clearly the shape and size of the peg and the board supervene on the microproperties. Do these microproperties provide an answer to the above question? Putnam says not, because the details at that level are irrelevant to why the peg did not penetrate the board: the microproperties could have been very different, in fact, and the result would have been the same. What are we to conclude from this? That the “peg/board/hole”-level features (the macroproperties) are autonomous, so that they cannot be reduced to lower-level features (the microproperties). This is, more or less, just multiple realizability again, but here it keys in to an interesting aspect of that concept. It tells us that what is explainable using supervenient features is not always explainable using the associated subvenient features. Here one can make connections traditional issues with philosophy of science.

There are dissenting voices to Putnam’s thesis, but we shall not go any further into the ins and outs of the debate here since it quickly becomes dense and complex. Suffice it to say that supervenience is still “live” in many philosophical debates and will no doubt continue to remain so for some time to come.

6. Adding Mystery to Mystery?

Supervenience is something of a halfway house. It is called upon by some to ground a view according to which certain properties that we think of as “unphysical” are not definable in terms of, or reducible to physical properties and yet are nonetheless connected in some way. It is supposed to somehow avoid the mystery of how physical matters can have a determinative role to play in unphysical properties, without those unphysical properties causing a problem in being materialistically un-kosher. For others, supervenience is a reductive principle, a matter of how the world is and must be.

Many philosophers have complained about the (in)significance of supervenience. Stephen Schiffer suggests that the invocation of supervenience simply moves the explanatory task back a step. How, he asks,

could being told that non-natural moral properties stood in the supervenience relation to physical properties make them any more palatable? On the contrary, invoking a special primitive metaphysical relation of supervenience to explain how non-natural moral properties were related to physical properties was just to add mystery to mystery, to cover one obscurantist move with another.

(Schiffer 1987, p.153-4)

Much recent work has been devoted to decrying the philosophical utility of specific formulations of supervenience, the general idea, or proving equivalences between them. All of the formulations we have seen do no more than to chart certain correlations between properties. They do not tell us anything about dependency or determination between the properties, in the sense of, say, a causal relation. Supervenience directs us to search for the underlying reasons for the correlation—it might not always be there. In the case of the special sciences it isn’t clear that an “underlying reason” is to be found. Kim (1987, p. 167), for example, believes that supervenience is not a “deep” metaphysical relation, but instead is a superficial relation that points to some other ‘deeper’ relation that might explain the superficial pattern of dependency—though more recently Kim has shifted to a reductive view of the relation (see Kim, 2005, for a clear account). In this sense, supervenience is a useful concept, for it can function as a filter on types of relations, letting through those of a certain type. Once we have identified a dependence relation, we can then delve deeper to see what might account for it: causation, mereology, definition, emergence, and so forth. In this sense there is no question of supervenience being an explanatory device, so there is no mystery here; but it can nonetheless be used in the search for explanations.

Supervenience has many useful applications too, in making other areas of philosophy clearer and more navigable. For example, the internalism/externalism distinction concerning mental content [very roughly, externalism is the view that mental content depends on things outside of the mind as well as inside; internalism denies this—saying that only what’s inside matters] can be cast into the endorsement and denial respectively of the following supervenience thesis: the content of a mental state (that is, what it is about) supervenes on certain neurobiological properties (narrow content). On the other hand, the externalist, as can be discerned from the rough characterization above, believes that there is more to content than this: the world plays a role too. One can clarify the distinction between internal and external relations too: an internal relation is one that supervenes on the intrinsic properties of its relata (for example, being heavier than), while this is not true in the case of external relations (for example, being 2 miles away from); it does not matter what something is like for it satisfy this latter relation, but it does for the former. We have seen too that it allows for a definition of physicalism and helps with the puzzle of material coincidence. Surely, if by a concept’s work shall you know it, supervenience deserves the central place that it has found in the philosophers’ toolbox.

7. References and Further Reading

For a more technical and detailed presentation of the concept of supervenience, see McLaughlin and Bennett’s article in the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.

Beckermann, A., Flohr, H., & Kim, J., (eds.). Emergence or Reduction? Essays on the Prospects of Nonreductive Physicalism. Berlin: Walter de Gruyter, 1992.
Davidson, D. 1970. “Mental Events.” In D. Davidson (ed.), Essays on Actions and Events, 1980: 207-225.
Davidson, D. “The Material Mind.” In P. Suppes (ed.), Logic, Methodology and the Philosophy of Science. North-Holland. Reprinted in Essays on Action and Events (Oxford University Press, 1980).
Fodor, J. “Special Sciences, or the Disunity of Science as a Working Hypothesis.” Synthese, 1974, 28: 97-115.
Hare, R.M. The Language of Morals. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1952.
Hellman, G. & Thompson, F. “Physicalism, Ontology, Determination, and Reduction,” The Journal of Philosophy, 1975, 72: 551-64.
Horgan, T. “From Supervenience to Superdupervenience: Meeting the Demands of a Material World.” Mind, 1993, 102: 555-86.
Horgan, T. (ed.) Southern Journal of Philosophy 22: The Spindel Conference 1983 Supplement. Supervenience, 1984.
Jackson, F. From Metaphysics to Ethics. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1998.
Kim, J. Supervenience, or Something Near Enough. Princeton University Press, 2005.
Kim, J. Supervenience and Mind. Cambridge University Press, 1993.
Kim, J. “Concepts of Supervenience.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 1984, 45, 2: 153-176.
Kim, J. “Supervenience as a Philosophical Concept.” Reprinted in J. Kim, Supervenience and Mind, 1993 (1990): 131-160.
Kim, J. “’Strong’ and ‘Global’ Supervenience Revisited.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 1987, 48, 2: 315-326.
Lewis, D.K. The Plurality of Worlds. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1986.
Lewis, D. K. “Reduction of Mind.” In D. Lewis (ed.), Papers in Metaphysics and Epistemology. Cambridge University Press, 1999 (1994): 291-324.
McLaughlin, B. & Bennett, K. “Supervenience.” The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Fall 2005 Edition), edited by Edward N. Zalta.
McLaughlin, B.P. “The Rise and Fall of British Emergentism.” In A. Beckermann et al. (eds.), Emergence or Reduction? Essays on the Prospects of Nonreductive Physicalism. Walter de Gruyter, 1992: 49-93.
McLaughlin, B.P. “Varieties of Supervenience.” In E. Savellos & U. Yalcin (eds.), Supervenience: New Essays. Cambridge University Press, 1995: 16-59.
Moore, G.E. Philosophical Studies. London: Routledge, 1922.
Paull, C.P. & Sider, T.R. 1992. “In Defense of Global Supervenience,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 32, 1992: 830-45.
Post, J. F. “Comment on Teller.” In Horgan (ed.), The Spindel Conference 1983 Supplement. Supervenience, 1984: 163-167.
Putnam, H. “Philosophy and our Mental Life.” In Mind, Language, and Reality. Cambridge University Press, 1975.
E. Savellos & U. Yalcin (eds.), Supervenience: New Essays. Cambridge University Press, 1995.
Schiffer, S. Remnants of Meaning. Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press, 1987.
Sober, E. The Nature of Selection: Evolutionary Theory in Philosophical Focus. University of Chicago Press, 1993.
Stalnaker, R. “Varieties of Supervenience.” Philosophical Perspectives 10, 1996: 221-241.
Teller, P. “A Poor Man’s Guide to Supervenience and Determination.” In Horgan (ed.), The Spindel Conference 1983 Supplement. Supervenience, 1984: 137-50.

Author Information

Dean Rickles
Email: drickles@ucalgary.ca
University of Calgary

Moral Realism

The moral realist contends that there are moral facts, so moral realism is a thesis in ontology, the study of what is. The ontological category “moral facts” includes both the descriptive moral judgment that is allegedly true of an individual, such as, “Sam is morally good,” and the descriptive moral judgment that is allegedly true for all individuals such as, “Lying for personal gain is wrong.” A signature of the latter type of moral fact is that it not only describes an enduring condition of the world but also proscribes what ought to be the case (or what ought not to be the case) in terms of an individual’s behavior.

The traditional areas of disagreement between the realist camp and the antirealist camp are cognitivism, descriptivism, moral truth, moral knowledge, and moral objectivity. The long and recalcitrant history of the realism/antirealism debate records that the focal point of the debate has been shaped and reshaped over centuries, with a third way, namely, Quasi-realism, attracting more recent attention. Quasi-realism debunks the positions of both realism and antirealism.

On the one hand, considering cognitivism, descriptivism, moral truth, moral knowledge, and moral objectivity as specifying the sufficient conditions for moral realism ignores the quasi-realist way. On the other hand, defining moral realism in a way that accommodates quasi-realism concedes too much: unlike the moral realist, the quasi-realist denies that moral facts are explanatory. Consequently, one can view quasi-realism as the contemporary heir of antirealism.

The Realism/Antirealism Debate
Quasi-Realism, Antirealism, and the EI thesis
1. An Analogy: Quasi-Realism about Derogatory Judgments
2. Quasi-Realism, Antirealism, and Explanationist Moral Realism
Moral Realism after Quasi-Realism
References and Further Reading

1. The Realism/Antirealism Debate

If there are moral facts, how can we know them? For a realist, moral facts are as certain as mathematical facts. Moral facts and mathematical facts are abstract entities, and as such, are different in kind from natural facts. One cannot literally display moral facts as one could display, say, a plant. One can display a token of the type, for example one can write “lying for personal gain is wrong” or one can write an equation; however, one cannot observe moral and mathematical facts in quite the same way as one can observe, with the aid of a microscope, clorophyll in a leaf. Such limitations of experience do not stop realists and antirealists from disagreeing on virtually every aspect of the moral practices that seem to presuppose the existence of moral facts. The list of contested areas includes moral language, moral truth, moral knowledge, moral objectivity, moral psychology, and so on. These areas are not discrete but intermingle.

The moral realist may argue for the view that there are moral facts as follows:

(1) Moral sentences are sometimes true.

(2) A sentence is true only if the truth-making relation holds between it and the thing that makes it true.

(3) Thus, true moral sentences are true only because there holds the truth-making relation between them and the things that make them true.

Therefore,

(4) The things that make some moral sentences true must exist.

It is a short inference from the existence of the things that make some moral sentences true to the existence of moral facts.

The moral antirealist can respond to the argument by denying any of the three premises. The antirealist could be a non-descriptivist in rejecting premise (1): no moral sentences are true for they do not describe how the world is; or, she may reject a version of the correspondence theory of truth by denying premise (2): she may argue that a sentence can be true even if there holds no truth-making relation between it and the thing that makes it true. For instance, she may be a proponent of the coherence theory of truth, which holds that a sentence can be true only when there is a truth making relation between it and other sentences relevant to it. Or, she may even reject as illegitimate the inference from “things that make some moral sentences true” to the “existence of moral facts.”

In the past, many antirealists were noncognitivists, holding that moral judgments are not cognitive states like ordinary beliefs: that is, antirealists hold that unlike beliefs, the essential function or aim of moral judgments is not to represent the world accurately. (A non-descriptivist claim is that cognitivism —more specifically descriptivism— is necessary, but not sufficient for moral realism, as will be shown presently.) Moral judgments are, according to the noncognitivist, mental states of some other kind: they are emotions, desires, or intentions of the sort that are expressed by commands or prescriptions.

If moral judgments are expressed by commands or prescriptions, then there cannot be literal moral truths. (Cf. Wright 1993. He argues that the focal discussion in the realist/antirealist debate should be about the acceptable theories of truth.) If there are no literal moral truths, then no moral judgments may be cited as evidence for knowing how the world is. Moral knowledge can no longer be considered as descriptive or propositional; or, no one is justified in believing certain things about the world in making moral judgments. This illustrates how the noncognitivist analysis of moral judgments can be escalated into the antirealist rejection of (those good names that we take for granted when we participate in moral practices such as) “moral truths” and “moral knowledge.” The antirealist’s noncognitivism threatens moral objectivity as well. Objectivity is to be found within the world. If moral judgments are not about accurately describing the world —for example, if moral judgments are about us —then moral objectivity will not be found within the world. If moral objectivity is to be found within us, then it is not the same objectivity with which we began, or, so had been the old antirealist’s way.

a. Cognitivism

If it is noncognitivism that provides the antirealist a way of rejecting moral truth, moral knowledge, and moral objectivity, the denial of noncognitivism (that is, cognitivism) must be necessary for the realist to properly claim them. Cognitivism is the view that moral judgments are cognitive states just like ordinary beliefs. It is part of their function to describe the world accurately. The realist argument that stems from cognitivism — as we saw from the above argument— is oftentimes guided by the apparent difficulties that the noncognitivist analysis of moral judgments faces. For instance, there is the famous Frege-Geach problem, namely, the noncognitivist difficulty of rendering emotive, prescriptive or projective meaning for embedded moral judgments.

Geach (1965) uses the “the Frege point,” according to which “a proposition may occur in discourse now asserted, now unasserted, and yet be recognizably the same proposition,” to establish that no noncognitivist (“the anti-descriptive theorist”) analysis of moral sentences and utterances can be adequate.

Consider a simple moral sentence: “Setting a kitten on fire is wrong.” Suppose that the simple sentence means, “Boo to setting a kitten on fire!” The Frege point dictates that the antecedent of “if setting a kitten on fire is wrong, then getting one’s friends to help setting a kitten on fire is also wrong” must mean the same as the simple sentence. But this cannot be because the antecedent of the conditional makes no such assertions while the simple moral sentence does. In other words, the noncognitivist analysis of moral sentences cannot be given to the conditional sentences with the embedded simple moral sentence. The problem can be generally applied to cases of other compound sentences such as “It is wrong to set a kitten on fire, or it is not.” Even if the noncognitivist analysis of the simple sentence were correct, compound sentences within which a simple moral sentence is embedded should be given an analysis independently of the noncognitivist analysis of it. This seems unacceptable to many. For the following argument is valid: “It is wrong to set a kitten on fire, or it is not; it is not ‘not wrong’; hence, it is wrong to set a kitten on fire.” If the argument is valid, then the conclusion must mean the same as one of the disjuncts of its first premise. The argument would be otherwise invalid because of an equivocation, and the noncognitivist seems to be forced to say that the argument is invalid.

The Frege-Geach problem demonstrates the noncognitivists’ requirement of adequately rendering emotive, prescriptive, expressive, or projective meaning of those moral sentences that are embedded within compound moral sentences. (For more on the Frege-Geach problem, see Non-Cognitivism in Ethics. See also Darwall, Gibbard, and Railton 1992: 151-52.)

The cognitivist understanding of moral judgments is at the center of moral realism. For the cognitivist, moral judgments are mental states; moral judgments are of the same kind as ordinary beliefs, that is, cognitive states. But how are we to know this? One manageable way is to focus on what we intend to do when we make moral judgments, and also on how we express them. Moral judgments are intended to be accurate descriptions of the world, and statements express moral judgments (as opposed to command or prescription) just as statements express ordinary beliefs. That is, statements express moral language. The statements that express moral judgments are either true or false just as the statements that express ordinary beliefs are. Moral truths occur when our signs match the world.

Language allows us to communicate with one another, typically using sentences and utterances. A large part of language involves, among many other things, influencing others and us. Normative language, in contrast with descriptive language, includes moral language (that is, moral language is part of evaluative or normative language). It is even more important not to be swayed by moral language because moral reality grips us. It is bad that others try to deceive us, but it is worse that we deceive ourselves into accepting moral facts simply because of the language that we use. That is, moral language — if it is not to describe the world —must not be mistaken as descriptive. Moral language binds us in a certain manner, and the manner in which it binds us is important.

i. Descriptivism

Moral language and descriptive language share the same syntactic structure. “Sam is good” predicates a kind of goodness to Sam just as “Sam is four-legged” predicates having four legs to her. “Being good” as in “being good is being able to bear one’s own scrutiny” and “having four legs” as in “having for legs is not required of being a dog” are both noun-like phrases. Again, to say, “If Sam is good, then she will be able to bear her own scrutiny,” illustrates that moral predication could be embedded to form a compound sentence just as descriptive predication could. We use both parts of language with an equal ease. Almost all of us are proficient in using moral language. Most of us understand what others express with it; and, we are expected to have understood what moral language means. Few people would apply the term “morally permissible” to an apparent case of wanton cruelty. Furthermore, moral language is governed by the same fundamental rules of logic as descriptive language. For instance, one and the same action cannot be good and bad at the same time. (The philosophical rejection of moral facts remains popular, although this focal reliance on the logico-linguistic aspect of the moral practices is no longer fashionable. See Darwall, Gibbard, and Railton 1992, especially p. 123.)

From this, must we then infer that there are entities like “moral goodness” and “obligation” to which moral language refers in the world? Are the three characteristics of structural similarity between moral and descriptive languages, the equal ease with which we employ them, and the logical interplay between them good enough reasons for thinking that there are moral facts? Is it not possible that our ways of influencing others and ourselves are exactly where syntax and semantics of our language betray us and, consequently, that moral language suffers from a lack of referents analogous to terms such as “nothing,” the “present king of France,” do?

Either moral language describes (or, it is intended to describe accurately) the world or it does not. According to descriptivists, moral language describes the world. The descriptivist position has been thought as the mark of moral realism, while the non-descriptivist position as that of antirealism. This is captured as follows:

(C1) S is a moral realist if and only if S is a moral descriptivist.

So while one may hold that there are no moral facts, according to C1, one may not at the same time hold that moral language describes or is intended to describe the world. Again, one may not hold both that there are moral facts but that our languages about them do not describe the world. For if C1 were true, being a moral realist and being a descriptivist about moral language are logically equivalent. So any non-descriptivist realism and any descriptivist antirealism would show that C1 is false. The possibilities will be discussed shortly in §2 and §3. Descriptivism and, hence, the truth-aptness of moral language. is discussed in more detail in what follows. (Ignored for the moment is what Blackburn calls “quietism” according to which “at some particular point the debate is not a real one, and that we are only offered, for instance, metaphors and images from which we can profit as we please” 1984, 146. One may claim quietism to be present in pretty much any important and interesting philosophical dispute, like “primary versus secondary, fact versus value, description versus expression, or of any other significant kind” 1998, 157. Quietism about whether moral language describes the world, if true, would render the traditional realism/antirealism debate over descriptivism as a dispute over no difference where there is nothing more than “the celebration of the seamless web of language” 1998, 157.)

Descriptivism in meta-ethics is a cognitivist view, according to which moral language describes (or, is intended to describe) the world. (Cf. Horgan and Timmons 2000, 124. This rough definition, according to them, falls under the dogma of the “[mistaken] semantic assumption: All genuinely cognitive content is descriptive content.” Conflating descriptivism with cognitivism is, according to them, “a largely unquestioned dogma.”) An inevitable corollary of descriptivism is that moral language is apt to truth evaluation; that is, statements express moral judgments that are either true or false. We may say alternatively that moral sentences express propositions without affecting the result of the discussion. As Nicholas Sturgeon puts it, “moral [sentences] typically express [statements] capable of truth and falsity” (1986, 116). Strictly speaking, then, descriptivism says little about, and remains neutral with respect to, the two views in moral epistemology: there are moral statements that are known to be true. Descriptivism does not tell us whether there is any moral statement known to be true. Nor does it tell us anything about the things by virtue of which moral statements are true when they are true. (Cf. Skorupski 1999. He thinks that descriptivism in conjunction without a substantial theory of truth is no descriptivism at all. There is just a terminological difference, and the descriptivism in conjunction with a substantial theory of truth will be discussed in section 2.)

The moral descriptivist believes that moral statements express moral judgments, and that they are either true or false. If every sentence that is capable of truth-value describes the world, then so does every moral statement. Moral language describes the world because every truth-apt sentence describes, or is intended to describe the world. The non-descriptivist denies that. The non-descriptivist believes that moral statements do not express moral judgments. Rather, the non-descriptivist believes that moral judgments are expressed by commands or prescriptions. Neither commands nor prescriptions are truth-apt, and as a result they typically are not meant to describe the world. Moral language does not describe the world, according to the non-descriptivist. That is, it represents our wishes, preferences, emotions, and so on, but it represents nothing over and above them. Figure 1 illustrates the disagreement between the descriptivist and the non-descriptivist. (Definite antirealist positions are marked with the dotted boxes in the figures that follow. An oval box will mark definite realist positions. See figure 5.)

Figure 1

Non-descriptivists disagree about exactly what moral language accomplishes, while they are unanimous about what it does not. G. E. Moore’s open question argument supports emotivism, a non-descriptivism contrary to his intention in the beginning of the 20th century. A. J. Ayer and C. L. Stevenson argue that moral judgments express feelings of approval or disapproval, or that making moral judgments is equivalent to emoting in reference to behaviors of others and ours. (See Ayer 1952 and Stevenson 1937, 1944, and 1963.) Stevenson says that, “Mr. G. E. Moore’s familiar objection about the open question is chiefly pertinent in this regard. No matter what set of scientifically knowable properties a thing may have (says Moore, in effect), you will find, on careful introspection, that it is an open question to ask whether anything having these properties is good,” (1937, 18). R. M. Hare’s universal prescriptivism, according to which “‘ought’-judgments are prescriptive like plain imperatives, but differ from them in being universalizable” (1991, 457) emphasizes that moral language facilitates ways of prescribing actions for all of us. The norm-expressivism of Allen Gibbard has renewed arguments for non-descriptivism recently. Rejecting emotivism, Gibbard,1990, holds that moral judgments are concerned about rational-to-have or justified moral sentiments, not just about feelings or preferences one has. Apparently, he holds that some moral feelings can be called rational-to-have or justified. It is when “one’s acceptance of norms that permit the feeling” (Darwall, Gibbard, and Railton: 1992, 150-51) is expressed, a feeling may be called rational-to-have. So while moral judgments (and moral language) are expressive of what we accept as norms, namely, a state of mind, they are not about describing the world, namely, non-descriptivism about moral judgment and language. Blackburn’s projectivism seems difficult to classify one way or another especially when it is considered in conjunction with his quasi-realism (Blackburn: 1984, 1993, and 1998). Moral language according to the projectivist lets us spin our own story onto the world. Non-descriptivists agree, nonetheless, that moral language is the tool of choice when we are panting for help, recommending a course of actions, passing judgments on what others do, and so on, but it is never the tool for describing the world.

The views discussed above can be illustrated with an example. Consider the moral sentence, “Petal ought to avoid eating too much.” The utterance of the sentence expresses the speaker’s judgment about Petal and perhaps about her tendency to the excessive consumption of food. The cognitivist holds that the speaker’s judgment is of the same kind as ordinary beliefs, that is the cognitivist holds that the speaker’s moral judgment is a cognitive state. Beliefs are representations of how things are, namely, possible states of affairs; and, language typically expresses beliefs. According to the cognitivist, then, the moral sentence that expresses the moral judgment represents a possible state of affairs. We may say that the descriptivist maintains that the moral sentence describes what ought to be the case about Petal and her tendency toward food. Petal could be instantiating the property of the “oughtness” of avoiding the excessive consumption of food, although this is not the only cognitivist way of maintaining her descriptivism about moral language. Just as the morning star refers to Venus, the linguistic item “ought to avoid eating too much” may refer to a moral property. It might even be maintained that there obtains the referential relation between moral expressions and the things in the world that they are supposed to pick out.

Noncognitivists hold that the speaker’s judgment in saying, “Petal ought to avoid eating too much,” is not of the same kind as cognitive states. Some noncognitivists go further and deny that the moral sentence represents a possible state of affairs. That is, some noncognitivists are non-descriptivists as well. The non-descriptivists maintain that the surface structure of moral language—and the logical interplay it displays within our use of it—is not a good guide in understanding what moral language does for us (and what we intend to do with it). The word “nothing” picks out no object whatsoever, although it serves as a grammatical subject; the definite description the “present King of France” refers to no one, although its article “the” indicates a unique satisfier of the description, and so on. These are familiar cases (of our language betraying us ontologically). So, part of the non-descriptivist claim is that moral language ontologically manipulates us just as “nothing” and the “present king of France” do. The merit of the view according to which there lurks a deeper structure (or meaning) to our moral language must be judged on how successful the non-descriptivist construal of the sentence about Petal is.

The non-descriptivist construal of “Petal ought to avoid eating too much” varies. Emotivism construes it as the way of emoting the speaker’s disapproval of Petal’s excessive consumption of food, or the way of informing Petal of her feeling. The expressivist construes it as the speaker’s way of expressing her preference with regard to Petal’s eating habit. The prescriptivist construes it as the way of commanding Petal to not eat excessively. The norm-expressivist construes it as the way of expressing the speaker’s non-acceptance of the norms that allow such a consumption of food. Perhaps the projectivist would construe the statement about Petal as a way of “objectifying” the speaker’s disapproval. However, all reject that there is a dyadic relationship of reference or correspondence, between the moral sentence and how the world is. The dyadic relation has all but been reduced to the monothetic relation of showing/manifesting the speaker’s psychological state. (The truth of this does not entail that people do not believe in moral principles. A. J. Ayer says that “[t]o say…that these moral judgments are merely expressive of certain feelings, feelings of approval or disapproval, is an over simplification” 1954, 238.) Figure 2 diagrams the non-descriptivist positions.

Figure 2

The contrast between descriptivism and non-descriptivism seems inapt for Gilbert Harman’s relativism because his relativism is a definite moral antirealist position. He rejects the objective status of moral facts. (See his 1977, 1986, and 2000; see also Harman and Thomson 1996 in which an interesting discussion of reasons both for and against moral objectivity is presented.) The relativist maintains that there are some ethical questions that can be correctly answered with “yes” for one, and “no” for another. Her claim implies nothing concerning for what moral language is meant. Error theorists maintain that moral judgments systematically err by positing moral facts. (For instance, Mackie says that “[t]he assertion that there are objective values or intrinsically prescriptive entities or features of some kind, which ordinary moral judgments presuppose is, I hold it not meaningless but false” 1977, 40.) That is, moral language aims to get the world right, but it always misses the mark. Mackie’s error theory in this respect occupies an important niche between the sides of the descriptivism divide and the sides of the moral realism divide. Figure 3 incorporates projectivism, relativism, and error theories, into figures 1 and 2.

Figure 3

The ontological ramification of accepting descriptivism (or, cognitivism) is not inevitably moral realism. Figure 3 indicates that descriptivism is not sufficient for moral realism. Mackie’s error theory is discussed in §2 in establishing the insufficiency. Blackburn’s projectivism, and John Skorupski’s “irrealist cognitivism” will be very briefly discussed as well. Descriptivism is nonetheless necessary for moral realism. The necessity is argued in §3 when Bruce Waller’s “megaethical level” is considered and rejected. That is, a conjunct of C1 will be shown to be false while the other conjunct of C1 will be shown to be true, thereby making the conjunction C1 false; more specifically, it will be shown that “if S is a moral descriptivist, thenS is a moral realist” is false and it will be shown that “S is a moral realist only if S is a moral descriptivist” is true.

ii. Mackie’s Error Theory

Is it true that S is a moral realist if and only if S is a descriptivist? That is, is C1 true? Any coherent descriptivist antirealism would establish that C1 is false. Another way that C1 could be shown to be false is to establish the possibility of non-descriptivist realism. The insufficiency of descriptivism will be established in this section. The realist territory, as it were, will not be properly marked by descriptivism.

Consider Mackie’s remark that:

The assertion that there are objective values or intrinsically prescriptive entities or features of some kind, which ordinary moral judgments presuppose is, I hold it not meaningless but false (1977, 40).

Moral judgments are false, or so the above-quoted passage reads. But why are they all false? It is because there are no entities to which moral language refers. Moral language purports to describe things that are not there. According to Mackie, it is a (perpetual) error to suppose that there are moral entities, thus, the name “error theory.” Mackie’s error theory is a prima facie descriptivist antirealist position: it maintains that there are no moral facts. In addition he accepts that moral judgments are meant to describe the world. Is this combination of moral antirealism and descriptivism plausible? Blackburn certainly thinks that it is not.

Blackburn, whose own view seems to be indeterminate between descriptivism and non-descriptivism, thinks that Mackie’s error theory is inconsistent. This is partly because of the apparent difficulty in attributing a pervasive systematic error to our making moral judgments. As Blackburn puts it, “[T]he puzzle is why, in the light of the error theory, Mackie did not at least indicate how a shmoral vocabulary [that is, a moral vocabulary cleansed of its ontological error] would look, and why he did not himself go on only to shmoralize, not to moralize.” According to Blackburn, this is so seriously puzzling that Mackie’s failure to shmoralize “in itself suggests that no error can be incorporated in mere use of those concepts” (1985, 2).

To try avoiding the pervasive and systematic error should appear reasonable to those who were aware of it. But Mackie seemed “quite happy to go on to express a large number of straightforward moral views [namely, to moralize rather than to shmoralize]” (Blackburn 1985, 1).

Does Blackburn’s charge establish that Mackie’s antirealism and descriptivism combination is inconsistent? No, it does not. What Blackburn demands of Mackie is the consistent deployment of his meta-ethical view in his moral practice. But to lead a moral life strictly according to one’s meta-ethical view requires heroic efforts. Try imagining an error theorist deploying his meta-ethical views when it comes to the existence of an external world! She cannot help but conduct her business as if it is no error in thinking that there exists a world external to her. It is impossible for her to show that it is an error to believe in the existence of such a world. More generally, the second-order beliefs on the first-order moral practices are rarely made explicit. Everyday moral practices (within which Mackie continues to moralize) are not a translucent showcase for meta-ethical views. So, Blackburn fails to establish that descriptivist antirealism is inconsistent. That is, Blackburn should expect no explicit display of Mackie’s error-theoretic commitments.

Blackburn’s projectivism may qualify for the descriptivist antirealism. (Blackburn’s descriptivism will be discussed in §2 of section 1.2 in more detail.) Moral language has content, according to Blackburn, but the content is not determined by the world. The content of moral language is determined rather by what “the mind [expresses as] a reaction by ‘spreading itself on the world’” (Blackburn 1984, 75). That moral language has content suggests that part of its function is to accurately describe the world. At the same time, Blackburn’s projectivism is an antirealist position because he maintains that the content is somehow “written” by us.

There are other recent theories that result from explicit attempts at combining descriptivism and antirealism. Hatzimoysis says “a minimalist conception of truth fits the bill of antirealist cognitivism in ethics.” (See for example, Hatzimoysis 1997, 448.) Skorupski’s “irrealist cognitivism” is one such theory. He argues for it by denying “all content is factual content” (1999, 438).

The fact that moral language expresses cognitive states, that is, that moral language has descriptive content, according to Skorupski does not guarantee the existence of moral facts; nor does it justify belief in the existence of moral facts. (Cf. Horgan and Timmons 2000. They distinguish three different kinds of content: declarative, cognitive, and descriptive.) Skorupski says that “normative claims are truth-apt contents of cognition…but their truth is not a matter of correspondence or representation” (1999, 436). The truth-apt fragment of language is truth-apt because of its descriptive content. So the first conjunct of Skorupski’s remark is descriptivist. But when moral language is true (or false), it is so not because it corresponds to the world: there is nothing that answers to moral language. That is, Skorupski rejects the existence of moral facts, and his position is hence antirealism.

Is Skorupski’s irrealist cognitivism consistent? Descriptivism by no means entails the correspondence theory of truth, and Skorupski’s antirealism is based solely on his denial of the correspondence theory of truth. Irrealist cognitivism is hence consistent.

Mackie’s error theory, Blackburn’s projectivism, and Skorupski’s irrealist cognitivism are instances of descriptivist antirealism. We may then conclude that moral descriptivism is not sufficient for moral realism. But is it a necessary condition for moral realism? If it is, then we may hope to mark the proper realist territory by adding additional necessary conditions. (My emphasis on consistency of maintaining both descriptivism and antirealism is not meant to suggest that a descriptivism/non-descriptivism debate as represented by, say, the Frege-Geach problem which claims that embedded moral language appears to have descriptive contents rather than emotive, prescriptive or projective content, is not as important and relevant to the realism/antirealism debate. See Darwall, Gibbard, and Railton 1992, especially pp. 151-152.) The necessity of descriptivism for realism will be discussed in the following section. Another conjunct of C1, “S is a moral realist only if Sis a descriptivist” will be examined.

iii. Waller’s Megaethical Level

Few philosophers take the noncognitivist realist position seriously. For instance, Geoffrey Sayre-McCord (1988, 9-14) dismisses it quickly as inconsistent. But noncognitivist realism is certainly a logical possibility. In this section, we shall examine Waller’s arguments for its tenability.

Waller’s noncognitivism is attenuated: moral judgments are not cognitive states when no fundamental common values are in place. He says “noncognitivism insists that when fundamental value conflicts arise and basic value questions are posed, then the disputes and values are noncognitive” (1994, 63). Statements only express moral judgments when an assumed set of common fundamental values is present. Waller’s remark that “such independent moral conversion is evidence in favor of moral realism and against noncognitivism” sounds inconsistent with the label of his theory “noncognitivist moral realism.” (See his 1992, 129.) Waller’s remark makes it seem as if moral realism and noncognitivism are contradictory to each other. Waller’s strategy is to distinguish the “megaethical” level from the level where there are uncontested fundamental values. This allows Waller to maintain that at one level “the moral facts are internally real,” but at another level, namely, the megaethical level, “[the moral facts] are ideal” (1994, 67). Waller’s divide-and-conquer strategy entitles him to either cognitivist moral realism at the level of assumed values, or noncognitivist antirealism at the megaethical level. So Waller’s “noncognitivist realism” fails as a noncognitivist realist position. We may then conclude that cognitivism (or, descriptivism) is necessary for moral realism. Cognitivism, the view that moral judgments are cognitive states like ordinary beliefs (with its two corollaries, namely, descriptivism and their truth-aptness), could facilitate the realist/antirealist debate, but cognitivism alone is not sufficient in facilitating the discussion, not solely in its terms anyway.

The necessity of cognitivism for realism may lead us to expect that specifying additional necessary conditions for realism could mark the proper realist territory. Cognitivism combined with some substantial theory of truth is taken up next.

b. Truth in Moral Judgments

Moral statements express judgments, and for some, moral statements describe the world. But moral realism is not present everywhere cognitivism (or, descriptivism) is present. That is, cognitivism and descriptivism, which had once crystallized the realism/antirealism debate, no longer do so. Crispin Wright’s recommendation that “moral anti-realists, for instance, should grant that moral judgments are apt for truth and falsity” (1993, 65) illuminates more recent discussions of the subject. Mackie’s error theory (1977), Skorupski’s irrealist cognitivism (1999), and perhaps Blackburn’s projectivism (for example, 1984) illustrate, as we saw earlier, the possibility of consistently combining cognitivism with antirealism.

An error theorist maintains her antirealism by insisting that moral judgments involve a pervasive error. No moral judgments are true, according to the error theorist, although they are truth-apt because they purport to describe the world. Moral realists part company with the error theorists over truth in moral judgments: some moral judgments are true. Still, this is not sufficient for moral realism. The projectivist functioning as a quasi-realist and Skorupski should be able to claim that some moral judgments are true. Moral truths can be literal or figurative; and, they can be the matter of correspondence or coherence (coherence with other already held beliefs stands in here for the range of “modified characteristics” of truth). Figure 4 illustrates this point:

Figure 4

Deflationist theorists of truth reject that the truth-predicate “is true” adds to the meaning of linguistic items. For instance, “snow is white” and “‘snow is white’ is true,” mean, according to them, the same. Deflationist theories include F. P. Ramsey’s redundancy theory of truth (or, the prosentential theory of truth) and Paul Horwich’s more recent minimalism. Inflationist (substantive or robust) theorists of truth, in contrast with deflationists, maintain that truth is a real and important linguistic item. Inflationist theories include the correspondence theory of truth, the coherence theory of truth, and the so-called pragmatic theory of truth. Inflationists disagree not only about the nature of the property of truth, but also disagree about the bearers of the property truth.

i. An Analogy

Consider the judgment, “Suffering from lack of food is bad.” The judgment is usually expressed with the statement “suffering from lack of food is bad.” Call it a “B-statement.” Sometimes, we find it necessary to express it with “it is true that suffering from lack of food is bad.” Call it a “T-statement.” (To complete it, there are “F-statements” like “it is false that suffering from lack of food is bad.”) We use T-statements to emphasize partiality toward “being true to the world.” However, regardless of what motivates us to use T-statements, the explicit ascription of truth in T-statements commands our attention. Does the T-statement add anything extra to the B-statement? If so, what is it that the T-statement says over and above the B-statement?

There are two broad ways to answer the question: deflationism and various forms of substantial theory (or what we called above “inflationist theory”). Substantial theorists deny that the B-statement and the T-statement are exactly the same while the deflationist maintains that the difference is merely stylistic. If the deflationist has her way, then it is obvious that antirealists could have truth in moral judgments. (David Brink argues against the coherentist theory of truth with respect to moral constructivism. See Brink 1989, 106-7 and 114; see Tenenbaum, 1996, for the deflationist approach.) Antirealist moral truths would seem irrelevant in marking the realist territory. If some form of substantial theory is true, then the T-statement adds something to what the B-statements say. Here are two alternatives.

Letting a coherence theory of truth stand in for the range of “modified theories” (namely, the inflationist theories of truth that are different from the correspondence theory of truth), and the “B-proposition” for what the B-statement describes about the world, the T-statement adds that:

(1) The B-proposition corresponds to an actual state of affairs.

(2) The B-proposition belongs to a maximally coherent system of belief.

It is worth noting also that even the non-descriptivist may say that the T-statement adds to the B-statement, insofar as the B-statement expresses something other than the B-proposition. The non-descriptivist has two alternatives as well.

The T-statement adds that (letting a coherence theory of truth stand in for the range of “modified theories,” and the “B-feeling-proposition” stand in for the range of non-descriptivism, for example, the speaker dislikes suffering from lack of food):

(3) The B-feeling-proposition corresponds to an actual state of affairs.

(4) The B-feeling-proposition belongs to a maximally coherent system of belief. We may say that the T-statement specifies truth conditions for the B-proposition or for the B-feeling-proposition. It could be objected that the non-descriptivist must deny that there are truth-conditions for moral language. Nonetheless, she need not object to moral language describing something about the world figuratively.

If option (1) were true, then there would have to be an actual state of affairs that makes the B-statement true. That is, there must be a truth-maker for the statement, “suffering from lack of food is bad,” and the truth-maker is the fact that suffering from lack of food is bad. But no other alternatives require the existence of the fact for them to be true.

If one ignores deflationism, truth in moral judgments gives rise to exactly four alternative theories of truth. Realists cannot embrace options (3) and (4) because, as we saw, non-descriptivism is sufficient for moral antirealism. The remaining option (2), although it is a viable option for the realist, falls short of guaranteeing that there are moral facts. In other words, moral realists must find other ways to establish the existence of moral facts, even if option (2) allows a way of maintaining moral truths for the realists. Modified theories, for example, the coherence theory of truth are simply silent about whether there are B-facts. That is, option (2) could be maintained even if there were no B-facts such as suffering from lack of food is bad. Thus, the most direct option for realists in marking her territory from the above list of alternatives is (1). It appears then that the correspondence truth in moral judgments properly marks the realist territory. This is captured in C2:

(C2) S is a moral realist if and only if S is a descriptivist; S believes that moral judgments express truth, and S believes that the moral judgments are true when they correspond to the world.

Is C2 true? No, it is not. For the antirealist may choose to deny that moral judgments literally describe the world. This is how Skorupski earns his antirealist title.

ii. Skorupski’s Irrealist Cognitivism

If C2 were true, then there could not be any cognitivist antirealist who believes that some moral judgments are true, and who also holds that moral truth is a matter of correspondence to the world. However, Skorupski’s irrealist cognitivism qualifies as one such position.

Skorupski maintains that moral judgments have truth-apt contents, but he denies that the contents of moral judgments are factual. Skorupski remarks “[normative language’s] truth is not a matter of correspondence or representation” (1999, 436). This remark may suggest that Skorupski’s irrealist cognitivism is a variant of option (2) above about what the T-statement adds to the B-statement. Nonetheless, there is an extension of Skorupski’s theory that would consistently allow it to fall within option (1). This extension of Skorupski’s theory would be a cognitivist antirealist position, combined with a correspondence theory of truth.

Moral statements express moral judgments, and as such, moral statements can be either true or false. What makes moral statements true when they are true? Skorupski’s remark above rejects that correspondence to the world is the truth-making relation. As was mentioned, this rejection could indicate that Skorupski holds a modified theory of truth or a deflationist theory. Perhaps he does, but it is not explicit. What is explicit is Skorupski’s denial that moral judgments have factual contents. How is it possible that some moral judgments are true if moral judgments are not factual? One way to answer it—and to extend Skorupski’s irrealism—is to maintain that moral judgments are not literal. Moral judgments are still expressed by moral statements, but what moral statements describe are not moral states of affairs. Moral statements express states of affairs of the world other than moral ones. In this way, moral statements can be true by corresponding to the world, once moral statements are recognized as describing, for example, a psychological aspect of the world.

Consider the statement “Santa Claus came early last year.” Call it the S-statement. (The “S-statement,” “T-statement,” “S-proposition,” “S-feeling-proposition,” and cognates are used as “B-Statement”, “T-Statement,” “B-proposition”, “B-feeling-proposition” and its cognates are above.) Does the S-statement describe the world as it was last year? Surely, it does. It reports either that (1) there was at least one person whose image fits the description of Santa, or that (2) there was the giver of toys around Christmas. It reports also that the person in either case came earlier than other years. Children are delighted by Santa’s early appearance in primarily the sense of (2). And they wonder, “Will Santa come early this year as well?” Similarly, children reason, “If Santa comes early, I will have an early Christmas present.” Of course, very few us of are Santa realists, although most of us are cognitivists about the S-statement in either sense.

How are adults able to maintain both cognitivism about the S-statement (more specifically descriptivism about it) and antirealism about Santa facts in the sense of S-statement (1)? Adults acknowledge the existence of surrogate toy-givers, while denying that the S-statement expresses the S-proposition in the sense of (1), namely, adults deny that there was at least one person whose image fits the description of Santa. Instead, adults believe that the S-statement expresses the S-feeling-proposition, or something equivalent to it. This is how one maintains antirealist cognitivism about Santa judgments.

There are many garden-variety Santa judgments. Santa judgments are expressed by Santa-statements, but no Santa-statements express the S-proposition. The S-statement does not involve the state of affairs in which there is the person whose name is Santa Claus. Nonetheless, the S-statement could be either true or false. Suppose that it is true, that Santa did come early last year, but suppose that we are also not realists about Santa Claus. We know better than those who are perplexed by the existence of people who fit perfectly the descriptions of Santa. We know that the S-statement does not say anything about a person named Santa Claus. For most, the S-statement is never about Santa, but rather it is about, for example, the toy-givers, the state of one’s national economy, and so on. That is, we deny that the S-statement expresses the S-proposition, however, this rejection does not force us to adopt deflationism or a modified theory of truth. The S-statement could express something true when it corresponds with the world as long as it expresses something other than the S-proposition. For instance, the S-statement expresses something true if the S-statement expresses the fact that the state of the national economy was good last year, and if the state of the national economy last year was actually good: in this case the S-statement expresses something true when it correctly reports the economy of last year. There is no inconsistency.

Analogously, moral statements express moral judgments. Insofar as moral statements are understood as expressing psychological facts about the world, moral statements can be true or false. Some “moral” statements are true in this way. Furthermore, they are true because they correspond to the world. Even if this is not Skorupski’s theory, it is an extension of his theory that instantiates cognitivist antirealism, combined with a correspondence theory of truth. This shows that C2 is false.

iii. The Correspondence Theory Requires Realism, Not Vice Versa

Our previous discussion of Skorupski’s cognitivist irrealism gives no details about the correspondence theory of truth it employs. It might be objected that such lack makes it impossible to judge whether or not Skorupski’s theory, or an extension of it, constitutes a counterexample to C2. But the “correspondence theory” is ambiguous between the general conception of truth that appeals to correspondence as the truth-making relation, and the very detailed analysis of truth that satisfactorily specifies the notion of truth in terms of the correspondence relation. As the general conception, the correspondence theory of truth is insufficient for moral realism. Antirealists are entitled to the correspondent truth of moral judgments insofar as moral judgments are understood “figuratively.” For as the general conception, the correspondence theory of truth imposes “for any proposition , it is true that just in case there is a way things could be such that anyone who believed, doubted, etc. that would believe, doubt, etc. that things were that way, and things are that way” (Wright 1999, 218). Apparently, the conception “offers little more than a long-hand version of the correspondence platitude,” and it “certainly carries no direct implications for the realism debate in its modern conception” because “there is so far no commitment to any specific general conception of the kind of relations that may be involved in truth, or of the nature of the non-propositional items in their fields” (Wright 1999, 223-24). On the other hand, as analysis, the correspondence theory perhaps is too strong for realism. The latter point will not be discussed further as our purpose here is to establish the non-sufficiency and the non-necessity of the correspondence theory of truth for moral realism. It seems reasonable to suppose that Skorupski’s irrealist cognitivism, or an extension of it, constitutes a counterexample to C2 as the general conception of correspondence theory of truth.

To sum up, consider the following five claims:

The correspondence theory of truth is false or implausible.
The correspondence theory of truth requires the truth of realism.
The correspondence theory of truth is not required for realism (and no particular theory of truth is).
“The correspondence theory of truth in conjunction with cognitivism” is not sufficient for realism.
“The correspondence theory of truth in conjunction with cognitivism and the correspondence (truth) of moral judgments” is not sufficient for realism.

The discussion of Skorupski’s (extended) antirealism aims at establishing claim (5), but since (5) implies (4) there is no need for independently establishing claim (4). Claim (1) is apparently bold, controversial, and not required for our purpose. Claim (2) seems false: an error theorist like Mackie is a moral antirealist, however, he may adopt a correspondence theory of truth and not contradict his particular brand of moral antirealism. Furthermore, claim (2) is not required for our purpose either. To properly mark the realist territory, we need not determine if the correspondence theory of truth— whether one considers it to be general theory or analysis—requires realism. Finally, claim (3) seems at least OK, and it is relevant to our goal. The T-statement discussed above, namely the T-statement that “‘Santa came early last year’ belongs to a maximally coherent system of beliefs,” shows that realists, moral or otherwise, are not forced to accept the correspondence theory of truth. That said, if moral realists opt for moral truths of the non-correspondence kind, then they would have to find other ways of establishing the existence of moral facts.

c. Literal Moral Truth?

In the previous section, it is proposed that one need not be a moral realist if she is a cognitivist that believes moral judgments express moral truths and that the truths they express are truths because of a correspondence between the judgments and facts in the world. The argument might attract the following response: such an antirealist position appears possible simply because it involves denying that there are any literal truths in moral discourse; even if cognitivism and moral truths that are obtained by employing a revisionary theory of meaning are considered to not be adequate for moral realism, then cognitivism and moral truths that are obtained on a literal understanding of moral language should be considered adequate for moral realism. This section offers replies to such a potential response.

Consider again the Santa statement, “Santa Claus came early last year.” An antirealist may construe it as saying

The national economy last year was good, and the economic boom was manifested by consumer confidence.

Consequently, the antirealist can say that because the S-statement expresses the S-feeling-proposition about the national economy and consumer confidence, nothing prevents the antirealist from adopting a correspondence conception of truth. Children, of course, insist that the S-statement is literal, that is, it expresses the S-proposition, “Santa Claus came early last year.” If the S-statement were to be taken literally, no antirealist could hold both that there are some Santa truths and that those Santa truths are matters of correspondence to the world. Santa antirealists cannot acknowledge any Santa fact if such an acknowledgement presupposes the existence of Santa, the person. The S-statement obviously express something other than the S-proposition, but is it the same with moral judgments and statements?

The preceding discussion signals a shift in the realist/antirealist debate. The literal meaning of moral language now comes to the fore of the discussion. We seem to have run a full circle. The non-descriptivist and the non-cognitivist point out that moral language may manipulate us ontologically because it misleads us into thinking that moral statements describe the world: obviously, the Santa statement cannot be taken literally. Even if it is unreasonable to insist on the literal interpretation of the S-statement, the same cannot be maintained with an equal confidence about moral statements. It is not obvious that moral language must not be taken literally. We are certain that there is no such living person as Santa Claus: that is why we can be certain that the S-statement cannot be taken literally. Nonetheless, with respect to moral statements, the existence of moral facts is exactly the issue. As a result, we cannot be as certain about moral language as we are about the S-statement that it must not be taken literally.

Granted, one of the most deeply rooted realist and antirealist disagreements has been whether moral language expresses things literally. Should moral language be taken literally or in some revisionist fashion? Skorupski, an antirealist cognitivist, must maintain that moral language describes the world, yet it does not do so literally. For instance, it expresses our ways of influencing others and ourselves. Realists, on the other hand, must maintain that moral language describes the world, and it does so literally. Moral language comes with shades of normativity, but that does not entail that moral language cannot be taken literally. Instead, the logico-linguistic considerations prove that moral language is no different from ordinary declarative statements that express ordinary beliefs. How are we to decide between the two? Does “species-ism is as (morally) bad as racism” express whatever it expresses literally? Is it even feasible to apply literalism, in the first place, to the realist/antirealist debate?

Surely, it is difficult to decide between the two above-mentioned alternatives. Language allows many things for us. For example, people sometimes disagree about whether an utterance expresses a genuine question or whether it expresses an assertion (in the form of a rhetorical question). This indicates that it can be difficult to know when a statement is to be taken literally and when it is not. If literalism were to carry any weight for the realism/antirealism debate, then there should be some independent way of telling when a statement is to be taken literally. That is, literalism about moral language requires an independent footing. Furthermore, it is very difficult to imagine that the long and recalcitrant history of the realist/antirealist debate has been just about the literal meaning of moral language. We presumably understand what moral statements express, if only in a rudimentary fashion. The disagreement about literalism may help explain why moral realists and antirealists often seem to talk past each other. Nevertheless, attributing different meaning to moral terms fails to further our inquiry. At any rate, it does not seem feasible to make literalism a criterion for moral realism, especially when the difficulty associated with literalism about moral language is considered.

d. Moral Knowledge

Some moral judgments are literally true, but some truths are not known. It is sometimes thought that we get moral facts right, while others get them totally wrong. Is there any merit to such a claim? Does one ever know a certain moral judgments to be true? (Joel Kupperman asks, for instance, “[i]f there is some set of moral truths, or approximately correct moral beliefs, independent of our feelings, attitudes, or opinions, then how can we ever know that we have found or arrived at them?” 1988, 33.) We get some moral facts right sometimes, according to the realist. That is, we succeed in knowing certain moral judgments to be true. Moral realism implies some sort of literal success theory, and so moral knowledge is implied by it. Or, moral realism entails at least the possibility of such knowledge.

Moral realists hold that we can have justified true moral beliefs, or that we can have warranted moral beliefs, according to some post-Gettier theories of knowledge. (See, for instance, Alvin Plantinga’s discussion of “warrant.”; See Gettier, 1963, and Plantinga, 1993a and 1993b). Some moral antirealists deny this. For example, Mackie’s error theory insists that no moral judgments are known to be true because the moral statements that express them always describe the world falsely. It is impossible to know something false as true! Moral skeptics hold that no moral judgments are justified or warranted. The epistemic success claim at once provokes epistemological questions: under what conditions are we ever justified or warranted in holding moral beliefs? And, how can we truly say that we have correct moral facts?

In answer, some moral realists have adopted a coherentist theory of justification, while others have opted for foundationalism and intuitionism. For instance, David Brink adopts coherentism in defense of a naturalist version of moral realism. (See especially Brink 1989, 122-43.) Naturalistic epistemology also deserves a serious consideration. (Cf. Consider Jaegwon Kim’s worry of losing normativity. See Kim, 1988, and Quine, 1986.) Some theories of justification are able to accommodate moral knowledge more easily than others. A causal theory of knowledge and justification, for instance, is ill suited for the task. Alvin Goldman’s reliabilism may not be the best-suited theory for it either. (See Goldman, 1978, and 1986.) But it seems obvious that the belief that moral knowledge is possible can be maintained even with these externalist theories of justification. Consider, for instance, a version of reliabilism: S is justified in holding “that p” iff pis the result of a reliable cognitive process. One can be justified in holding that Doctor Evil is no good if the judgment results from a reliable cognitive process, say, for example, the cognitive process that results in Austin Powers being good.

The possibility of moral knowledge does not entail moral realism, even though moral realism entails moral knowledge. As was shown above, there is nothing to stop the moral antirealist from claiming moral knowledge once she helps herself to cognitivism, moral truths, and some theory of justification. On the other hand, moral realists need not be shy about adopting an externalist epistemology either. A naturalistic realist would hope that moral knowledge is on a par with empirical knowledge. The realist may even agree that the paradigm justification for empirical knowledge is perceptual and is thus causal. The moral realist would have to reject causal reductionism, according to which the causal power of the supervening facts is entirely reducible to that of base facts. Moral judgments are true just in case they correctly report the supervening facts that depend on the non-moral base facts.

e. Moral Objectivity

Moral realists maintain that some literal moral truths are known, or that we are justified in holding them. Moral judgments are true just in case they correctly report the supervening facts that depend on the non-moral base facts. But are moral facts—the supposed truth-makers of moral judgments—objective? It could be the case that no ethical judgments are true independently of the desires or emotions that we happen to have, or, there could be different yet valid answers to the same ethical question as ethical relativists insist. Neither subjectivists nor relativists are obliged to deny that there is literal moral knowledge. Of course, according to them, moral truths imply truths about human psychology. Moral realists must maintain that moral truths —and hence moral knowledge—do not depend on facts about our desires and emotions for their truth. For instance, W. D. Falk analyzes the good as “a dispositional property of things as ideally assessed, a power to evoke favor by way of an ideal assessment” (Piker 1995, 102). Having objective literal moral knowledge seems to be sufficient for moral realism because no moral antirealists would acknowledge the possibility of such knowledge. Figure 5 summarizes the results of the discussion from 1.1-1.5.

Figure 5

We finally arrive at the definite moral realist position, which is marked by the oval box above. The combination of cognitivism, descriptivism, success theory, literalism, and objectivism seems sufficient for moral realism. Nonetheless, there are a couple of reasons why the moral realist territory is better marked by the explanationist consideration. This consideration leads to explanationist moral realism according to which there must be moral facts because they are essential in our understanding of the world. Literalism faces uncertainty if one considers what moral sentences mean, a consideration that is not ideal for the realism/antirealism debate. Despite these categories, the advent of quasi-realism signals the new antirealist way. A quasi-realist can claim that cognitivism, descriptivism, moral truths, moral knowledge, and even moral objectivity, are within the antirealist camp.

2. Quasi-Realism, Antirealism, and the EI thesis

Quasi-realists such as R. M. Hare, Gilbert Harman, and Simon Blackburn promise to set people free from the unduly rigid ontology of moral realism, namely, the existence of moral facts. Quasi-realism would allow people to enjoy the traditional realist comforts such as moral truths, moral knowledge, and moral objectivity, without the realists’ baggage of commitments, theoretical burdens, and practical costs, or so they contend. It all sounds too good to be true, but such a possibility seems exciting: why insist on the existence of moral facts if all aspects of our moral practices, especially the realist-sounding ones, could be understood without the fact-multiplying realist ontology? Of course, the real question is this: is there anything significant that will be lost in our understanding of our moral practices if we were to settle for quasi-realism? A definite “yes” to the question has to be given, and we shall see why in this section.

The possibility that the quasi-realist extends to people is that quasi-realism poses no serious threat to the moral realist position. However, this quasi-realist contention— that by siding with quasi-realism nothing significant will be lost in our understanding of our moral practices—is simply mistaken. The quasi-realist loses some of the best explanations of events, states of affairs, and phenomena within the world: the quasi-realist must reject folk moral explanations. This is so, it will be argued, because the quasi-realist cannot accommodate folk moral explanations without reducing them to naturalistic explanations.

a. An Analogy: Quasi-Realism about Derogatory Judgments

Blackburn discusses derogatory judgments in his attempt to show how the quasi-realist allows for realist comforts. The quasi-realistic understanding of these judgments, according to Blackburn, allows for antirealist cognitivism about derogatory judgments, derogatory descriptivism, derogatory truth, derogatory knowledge, and even derogatory objectivity. The same may be said of the quasi-realistic understanding of moral judgments: for example, the quasi-realist might be entitled to cognitivism when it comes to moral judgments, descriptivism when it comes to moral language, moral truth, moral knowledge, and the quasi-realist perhaps may even be entitled to moral objectivity. Analogously to the quasi-realism about derogatory judgments, Blackburn claims that quasi-realists are entitled to all these, without being committed to the existence of moral facts as part of the supposed fabric of the world.

Blackburn’s derogatory judgments argument goes something like this: “Kraut” is an inherently derogatory expression. The judgment “Franz is a Kraut” is a cognitive state just like ordinary non-derogatory beliefs. It consists partly of the judgment that Franz is German. The sentence or utterance “Franz is a Kraut” expresses a statement that describes how the world is. The Franz sentence expresses something true, namely, that Franz is a German insofar as it expresses nothing further about him. But the Franz sentence expresses more than just his nationality. It also expresses that Germans, including Franz, are fit objects of derision. We may call this additional part the “derogatory judgment” of the Franz sentence. The Franz sentence expresses something false because, according to Blackburn, the part that expresses the derogatory judgment is false. No one is a fit object of derision solely because of his nationality. Consequently, the Franz statement describes the world falsely.

What makes the Franz statement false? What makes the Franz statement false is twofold: 1) no one is a fit object of derision solely because of his nationality, so, the statement is false because it has failed to refer to anything; and 2) there is no person in the world toward whom it is appropriate to have the derogatory attitude and/or intention that is expressed by way of the Franz statement. The quasi-realist may maintain that the truth or falsity of the Franz statement is to be determined by the existence or non-existence of the person toward whom it is appropriate to have such an attitude. Since there is no such person, the Franz statement is false. That is to say, the speaker of the Franz sentence speaks falsely because she reports a state of affairs as actual that is non-actual, namely she is falsely reporting that it is appropriate to have derogatory attitudes toward some people solely because of their nationality, although she may be correctly identifying Franz’s nationality as German. Truth or falsity in derogatory judgments may be found in the way that they correspond or do not correspond to the world.

Analogously, quasi-realists may earn the right to maintain cognitivism when it comes to moral judgments, descriptivism, moral truths, moral knowledge, moral objectivity, and so on. For the quasi-realist, the inner workings of moral language are such that they afford such realist-sounding expressions like moral truths without ever accepting the realist ontology.

b. Quasi-Realism, Antirealism, and Explanationist Moral Realism

The quasi-realist paints a rosy philosophical picture in which one can enjoy realist-sounding luxuries while not multiplying entities beyond necessity. Nonetheless, the nagging question remains: is it not better to have a real thing than to have a quasi-real thing, especially when the theoretical price is right? We must challenge the quasi-realist’s entitlement to be regarded as the contemporary heir of moral antirealism, and examine her reasons for thinking that quasi-realism is true. It is ethical relativism that wins Harman antirealist entitlements. Blackburn earns his spurs through projectivism that eventually allows for the ontological parsimony. But why do quasi-realists think their particular brand of antirealism is true? Both Harman and Blackburn give a surprisingly unanimous explanation. They call it the explanatory inadequacy thesis of the moral and it addresses the comparative explanatory inferiority of moral facts, the total lack of explanatory power of moral facts, or explanatory reductionism.

For instance, according to Blackburn, projectivism must be true because “we need to explain the ban on mixed worlds, and the argument goes that antirealism [projectivism] does this better than realism” (1984, 184). Harman thinks that ethical relativism—the view that “there is no single true morality”—must be true because it is a “reasonable inference from the most plausible explanation of moral diversity” (Harman and Thomson 1996, 8). Harman’s reason is a version of the explanatory inadequacy of moral facts thesis. It is the inadequacy thesis that entitles the quasi-realist to the antirealist parsimony. To mark the moral realist territory in such a way that implies the irrelevance view (the view that the explanatory inadequacy of moral facts does not constitute evidence against moral realism) ignores the fact that it is primarily the inadequacy thesis that entitles the quasi-realist to anti-realism. The explanatory power of moral facts is the only realist doctrine that is immune from quasi-realist debunking.

It is puzzling for the quasi-realist to advance the explanatory inadequacy thesis since she has ample room for accommodating folk moral explanations. She only needs to appeal to the putative moral facts as though they are real. The “as though” attitude does a yeoman’s work. It gives her the right to use notions such as bivalence, moral truth, moral knowledge, and so on. It seems rather arbitrary to stop at accommodating moral explanations. The quasi-realist’s dismissive attitude toward moral explanations is the quasi-realist’s qualification as an antirealist.

3. Moral Realism after Quasi-Realism

Such quasi-delicacies like quasi-moral-truths, quasi-moral-knowledge, or quasi-moral-objectivity allow for contemporary antirealist ways, but moral realists surely cannot rest content with them. Moral realists must find a way for not only rejecting the quasi-realist’s debunking of the disagreements between the traditional realist and the antirealist, but also a way for establishing “real” moral comforts. A couple of ways moral realists do this is by asserting the existence of objective literal moral truths and explanationist moral realism.

Figure 5 indicates an inflated way of establishing the realist’s ontological thesis, namely, that there are moral facts. On this inflated moral realism, the realist view turns out to be a jumble of 4 major theories in philosophy: cognitivism, descriptivism, literalism, and success theory. (The correspondence theory of truth is neither necessary nor sufficient for moral realism as we saw above.) Although the existence of objective literal moral truths may show that the aforementioned theories are jointly sufficient for moral realism, it ignores the quasi-realist’s ways of saying the realist-sounding things (the quasi-realist’s way in masquerading as moral realists, if you will). A less inflated way of marking the realist territory would be advisable, should there be such a way. This is because quasi-realists insist that they are as much entitled to cognitivism, descriptivism, moral truth, moral knowledge and even moral objectivity as moral realists. Their insistence effectively thwarts realist attempts at marking their territory by relying on the traditional disagreement between realists and antirealists mapped in figure 5.

Explanationist moral realism has been suggested as a way of blocking the alleged quasi-realist masquerade. It focuses on the significance of having moral explanations. The explanationist moral realist holds that moral facts genuinely explain events and states of affairs in the world. In a rough and ready way, the explanationist realist maintains that there are moral facts because they explain non-moral events. However, her claim is debated even within the realist camp. Some moral realists consider that explanatory adequacy (or, inadequacy for that matter) is irrelevant in establishing the truth of moral realism; and, it is no easy task to show that moral facts are genuinely explanatory (or, that the quasi-realist’s accommodation of moral explanations is not as robust as she claims it to be). Nonetheless, since explanationist moral realism is much simpler than the inflated moral realism of figure 5, explanationist moral realism demands the realist’s close attention.

4. References and Further Reading

Alston, William P. 1996. A Realist Conception of Truth. Ithaca: Cornell University Press.
Ayer, A. J. 1952. Language, Truth, and Logic. New York: Dover Publications.
Blackburn, Simon. 1981. “Rule Following and Moral Realism,” In Holtzman and Leich (1981).
Blackburn, Simon. 1984. Spreading the Word: Groundings in the Philosophy of Language. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Blackburn, Simon. 1993. Essays in Quasi-Realism. New York: Oxford University Press.
Blackburn, Simon. 1998. Ruling Passions: A Theory of Practical Reasoning. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
Blackburn, Simon, and Keith Simmons, eds. 1999. Truth. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Brink, David O. 1989. Moral Realism and the Foundations of Ethics. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Darwall, Stephen, Allan Gibbard, and Peter Railton. 1992. Toward Fin de siècle Ethics: Some Trends. The Philosophical Review, 101 (1):115-89.
Dodd, Julian. 2002. “Recent Work on Truth,” Philosophical Books, 43:279-91.
Fine, Kit. 2001. “The Question of Realism,” Philosopher’s Imprint 1, (1):1-30.
Geach, Peter. 1965. “Assertion,” The Philosophical Review, 74:449-465.
Gettier, E. L. 1963. “Is Justified True Belief Knowledge?” Analysis, 23 (6).
Gibbard, Allan. 1990. Wise Choices, Apt Feelings. Cambridge: Harvard University Press.
Goldman, Alvin I. 1978. “A Causal Theory of Knowing,” in Essays on Knowledge and Justification, edited by G. S. Pappas and M. Swain. Ithaca: Cornell University Press.
Goldman, Alvin I. 1986. “What is Justified Belief?” in Empirical Knowledge: Readings in Contemporary Epistemology, edited by P. K. Moser: Rowman & Littlefield Publishers, Inc.
Hare, R. M. 1952. The Language of Morals. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Harman, Gilbert. 1977. The Nature of Morality. New York: Oxford University Press.
Harman, Gilbert. 1986. “Moral Explanations of Natural Facts—Can Moral Claims Be Tested Against Moral Reality?” The Southern Journal of Philosophy, XXIV (Supplement):57-68.
Harman, Gilbert. 2000. Explaining Value and Other Essays in Moral Philosophy. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Harman, Gilbert, and Judith Jarvis Thomson. 1996. Moral Relativism and Moral Objectivity. Cambridge: Blackwell.
Hatzimoysis, Anthony. 1997. “Minimalism about Truth and Ethical Cognitivism,” in Analyomen, 2, Volume III: Philosophy of Mind, Practical Philosophy, Miscellanea, edited by G. Meggle. de-Gruyter: Hawthorne.
Horgan, Terence, and Mark Timmons. 2000. “Nondescriptivist Cognitivism: Framework for a New Metaethic,” Philosophical Papers, 29:121-153.
Horwich, Paul. 1998. Truth. 2nd ed. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
Kim, Jaegwon. 1988. What is “Naturalized Epistemology?” Philosophical Perspectives 2 (Epistemology):381-405.
Kupperman, Joel J. 1988. “Ethical Fallibility,” Ratio 1:33-46.
Lynch, Michael P. 1997. “Critical Study: Minimal Realism or Realistic Minimalism?” The Philosophical Quarterly 47 (189):512-518.
Piker, Andrew. 1995. “W. D. Falk’s Alternative to Moral Realism and Anti-Realism,” Auslegung 20 (2):100-105.
Plantinga, Alvin. 1993a. Warrant: the Current Debate. New York: Oxford University Press.
Plantinga, Alvin. 1993b. Warrant and Proper Function. New York: Oxford University Press.
Quine, W. V. O. 1986. “Epistemology Naturalized,” in Empirical Knowledge: Readings in Contemporary Epistemology, edited by P. K. Moser: Rowman & Littlefield Publishers, Inc.
Sayre-McCord, Geoffrey. 1988. “The Many Moral Realisms,” in Essays on Moral Realism. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press.
Skorupski, John. 1999. “Irrealist Cognitivism,” Ratio XII:436-459.
Stevenson, C. L. 1937. “The Emotive Meaning of Ethical Terms,” Mind 46:14-31.
Stevenson, C. L. 1944. Ethics and Language. New Haven: Yale University Press.
Stevenson, C. L. 1963. Facts and Values. New Haven: Yale University Press.
Sturgeon, Nicholas L. 1986. “Harman on Moral Explanations of Natural Facts,” The Southern Journal of Philosophy XXIV (Supplement):69-78.
Tenenbaum, Sergio. 1996. “Realists without a Cause: Deflationary Theories of Truth and Ethical Realism,” Canadian Journal of Philosophy 26 (4):561-90.
Waller, Bruce N. 1994. “Noncognitivist Moral Realism,” Philosophia 24 (1-2):57-75.
Wedgwood, Ralph. 2007. Nature of Normativity, Oxford University Press.
Wright, Crispin. 1992. Truth and Objectivity. Cambridge: Harvard University Press.
Wright, Crispin.1993. “Realism: The Contemporary Debate: Whither Now?” in Reality, Representation and Projection, edited by J. Haldane and C. Wright. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Wright, Crispin.1999. “Truth: A Traditional Debate Reviewed,” in Blackburn and Simmons (1999).

Author Information

Shin Kim
Email: skim@hufs.ac.kr
Hankuk University of Foreign Studies
Korea

Cognitive Relativism

Cognitive relativism asserts the relativity of truth. Because of the close connections between the concept of truth and concepts such as knowledge, rationality, and justification, cognitive relativism is often taken to encompass, or imply, the relativity of these other notions also. Thus, epistemological relativism, which asserts the relativity of knowledge, may be understood as a version of cognitive relativism, or at least as entailed by it.

This kind of relativism can take different forms depending on the nature of the standpoint or framework to which truth is relativized. If truth is relativized to the individual subject, for instance, the result is a form of subjectivism. If the standpoint is an entire culture, the result is some form of cultural relativism. Other possible frameworks include languages, historical periods, and conceptual schemes. These frameworks do not exclude one another, of course, and in the positions developed by thinkers such as Thomas Kuhn and Michel Foucault (both generally regarded as holding relativistic views of truth) they are presented as interwoven.

Cognitive relativism is not so widely held as moral relativism. Moral relativism is the view that moral judgments (those employing concepts like good, bad, right or wrong) should only be assessed relative to a particular, limited standpoint (usually that of a specific culture). This doctrine became a commonplace for many growing up in modernized societies in the second half of the twentieth century and is virtually the default position encountered among undergraduates by countless philosophy instructors today. One major reason for its popularity is the importance attached by so many thinkers to the distinction between facts and values. Factual judgments are generally thought to be objective and provable; value judgments, by contrast, are commonly held to express subjective attitudes and to be unprovable, rather like judgments of taste.

Gradually, however, cognitive relativism has gained in credibility as the sharp logical dichotomy between facts ands values has been increasingly questioned. Instead of a dichotomy, many now argue for a spectrum of judgments with a greater or lesser evaluative component to them. Moreover, these components themselves may not be seen as radically different; they may, for instance, simply reflect the degree to which a judgment is controversial within a particular community, with what we call factual judgments being the least disputed. From this point of view, cognitive relativism is broader and more fundamental than moral relativism, for it asserts that the truth value of all judgments, not just moral ones, is relative.

Ancient relativism
The emergence of relativism in modern times
The definition of relativism
Arguments for relativism
Objections to relativism
1. Relativism is Self-Refuting
2. Relativism has Pernicious Consequences
Conclusion
References and Further Reading

1. Ancient relativism

In Western philosophy, relativism first appears as a philosophical outlook associated with the Sophists in fifth century Greece. Cosmopolitan and skeptically inclined, these traveling intellectuals were struck by the variations in law, mores, practices and beliefs found in different communities. They drew the conclusion that much of what is commonly regarded as natural is in fact a matter of convention. There is thus no objectively right way to worship the gods or organize society, any more than there is an objectively correct way to dress or to prepare food. The main critical thrust of this way of thinking was directed against traditional moral and political values, but the relativity of truth itself seems to be implicated in Protagoras’ famous assertion that “man is the measure of all things–of things that are, that they are, and of things that are not, that they are not.” The fact that the sophists taught rhetoric, and in stressing the value of persuasion appeared indifferent to questions of truth, reinforced this attitude.

The first great critic of relativism was Plato. In the Theatetus, he links Protagorean relativism to the view that knowledge should be identified with sense perception, and also to the Heracleitean doctrine that reality is in a continual state of flux. Plato’s criticisms of Protagoras’ position prefigures arguments advanced against relativism by its critics ever since. One objection he raises is that relativism collapses the distinction between truth and falsity; for if each individual is really the “measure” of what is, then everyone would be infallible, which is absurd. The implausibility of the Protagorean thesis is especially obvious, Plato argues, when we consider two people making incompatible predictions about the future. Events will prove that one of them, at least, was not a good measure of what is true. His other main objection is that relativism is self-refuting. If Protagoras is right, then whatever a person thinks is true, is true. But in that case, Protagoras must concede that those who think relativism is false are correct. So if Protagorean relativism is true, it must also be false.

Although skepticism about the possibility of knowledge became part of the mainstream of ancient philosophy, relativism did not. Socrates and Plato may be willing to concede that human understanding, in this life at least, is very limited, but they do not doubt the existence of an ideal vantage point from which the objective truth about the world could be known. Also, Aristotle appears fairly confident that such a vantage point is accessible to human reason properly employed.

2. The emergence of relativism in modern times

Between Aristotle and Kant there are no major Western philosophers who one could plausibly describe as cognitive relativists. Montaigne and Hume certainly stressed the importance of custom in shaping peoples’ beliefs, especially on moral matters; but this led them towards skepticism rather than relativism. The door to modern relativism was unlocked by Kant’s claim in the Critique of Pure Reason that the only world we can know or talk about meaningfully is one that has been shaped by the human mind. On Kant’s view, the concept of “objective reality” is employed speculatively and hence illegitimately if it is taken to refer to reality as it is independent of our experience of it. This obviously has implications for the traditional notion of objective truth. The judgments we call true are true for us and of our world; but to claim they are true in the sense of describing an independently existing reality is to go beyond what we can meaningfully or justifiably assert.

Kant is not generally considered a relativist since he held that the forms our mind imposes on the world are common to all human beings. Truths like the truths of geometry or the statement that every event is caused are thus universally accepted and constitute a priori knowledge. The forms we impose on experience also give the world a certain necessary character that is independent of our beliefs and wishes. For instance, causes must precede their effect, and time can only flow in one direction. In this sense, the forms confer objectivity on the world we experience, and our well-founded judgments about that world can be called objectively true. Later thinkers, however, took Kant’s ideas further down the road toward fully-fledged relativism. Hegel, while upholding a concept of “absolute knowledge”, allows every stage that human consciousness has passed through in the historical development of civilization to express an outlook that is true in a partial way. Marx highlights the influence of the mode of production along with class and economic interests in shaping the way people understand their world; and although he appears to recognize the epistemic authority of science in some areas, he rejects the idea of a neutral standpoint from which to adjudicate between different views of social reality. Nietzsche is explicitly relativistic about both moral values and truth, preferring to evaluate claims according to what sort of will to power the claims express rather than according to their objective truth-value.

In the twentieth century, a relativistic view of truth can be found in or inferred from the work of many major philosophers, including James, Dewey, Wittgenstein, Quine, Kuhn, Gadamer, Foucault, Rorty, and most of those commonly labeled “postmodernists”. Numerous others, including some who regard themselves as staunch opponents of relativism, have been accused of harbouring relativistic tendencies. There is thus a general consensus that modern philosophy has shifted in a relativistic direction. Even fierce critics of relativism like Allan Bloom (author of The Closing of the American Mind) concede this. Indeed, it is this trend, along with its trickle down effect on the outlook of rising generations, that occasions lamentations such as his.

3. The definition of relativism

There is no general agreed upon definition of cognitive relativism. Here is how it has been described by a few major theorists:

“Reason is whatever the norms of the local culture believe it to be”. (Hilary Putnam, Realism and Reason: Philosophical Papers, Volume 3 (Cambridge, 1983), p. 235.)
“The choice between competing theories is arbitrary, since there is no such thing as objective truth.” (Karl Popper, The Open Society and its Enemies, Vol. II (London, 1963), p. 369f.)
“There is no unique truth, no unique objective reality” (Ernest Gellner, Relativism and the Social Sciences (Cambridge, 1985), p. 84.)
“There is no substantive overarching framework in which radically different and alternative schemes are commensurable” (Richard Bernstein, Beyond Objectivism and Relativism (Philadelphia, 1985), pp. 11-12.)
“There is nothing to be said about either truth or rationality apart from descriptions of the familiar procedures of justification which a given society—ours—uses in one area of enquiry” (Richard Rorty, Objectivity, Relativism and Truth: Philosophical Papers, Volume 1 (Cambridge, 1991), p. 23.)

Without doubt, this lack of consensus about exactly what relativism asserts is one reason for the unsatisfactory character of much of the debate about its coherence and plausibility. Another reason is that very few philosophers are willing to apply the label “relativist” to themselves. Even Richard Rorty, who is widely regarded as one of the most articulate defenders of relativism, prefers to describe himself as a “pragmatist”, an “ironist” and an “ethnocentrist”.

Nevertheless, a reasonable definition of relativism may be constructed: one that describes the fundamental outlook of thinkers like Rorty, Kuhn, or Foucault while raising the hackles of their critics in the right way.

Cognitive relativism consists of two claims:

(1) The truth-value of any statement is always relative to some particular standpoint;

(2) No standpoint is metaphysically privileged over all others.

The first of these claims asserts the relativity of truth, obviously an essential element in this form of relativism. Oddly, though, this is not the most controversial part of the doctrine. After all, even committed realists might be willing to conceive of objective truth as equivalent to “true from a God’s eye point of view” or “true from the standpoint of the cosmos”. It is this second claim, the denial of any metaphysically privileged standpoint, that most provokes relativism’s critics. A brief look at the role of this thesis in the thought of three leading relativists–Kuhn, Rorty, and Foucault—will help reveal why it should be so controversial.

In The Structure of Scientific Revolutions, Kuhn argues that science progresses by means of what he calls paradigm shifts. A paradigm theory is an overarching theory like Dalton’s atomic theory or the theory of evolution. These provide the background conceptual scheme within which what Kuhn calls “normal science” occurs. On Kuhn’s account, a paradigm shift such as that by which Copernican astronomy displaced the Ptoemeic view of the universe should not be thought of as a shift between two different ways of looking at an independent reality. Rather, theory and observation are so intertwined that the shift amounts to a change in the reality the scientists inhabit. Consequently, there is no independent standpoint from which a paradigm shift can be judged to take us closer to a true picture of the way things really are. Kuhn likens debates over paradigms to political controversies, saying that “as in political revolutions, so in paradigm choice—there is no standard higher than the assent of the relevant community.” (p. 110)

Richard Rorty extends what Kuhn says about science to every other sphere of culture, particularly politics. The traditional view–call it Platonist, absolutist, objectivist or realist–is that when we do something like abolish slavery we move closer to an independent ideal and we bring our way of thinking closer to the One Right Way, the way dictated by reason or by our essential human nature. Rorty thinks this sort of thinking has been valuable in the past; but in more recent times it has become constraining rather than liberating. He therefore urges us to see intellectual and cultural progress as simply consisting in our exchanging one vocabulary for another. Descriptions of human beings that view them as entitled to equal rights before the law, and descriptions of the solar system that views it as heliocentric are both preferable to the descriptions they replaced; but not because they are closer to the truth. In both cases, we should prefer the newer descriptions on pragmatic grounds; they better enable us to achieve our purposes.

Michel Foucault’s relativism is similar to Kuhn’s in being based on and justified by historical researches. The domain of his studies is different, however. In works like Madness and Civilization, The Order of Things, and Discipline and Punish, Foucault tries to show how what we call “reason”, “science”, “knowledge” and “truth” are socially constituted and shaped by political forces. He argues that in order to pass muster as “scientific” or as “rational”, a discourse must satisfy certain conditions, and these conditions are socially and historically relative, reflecting the needs and interests of existing power structures. This relativity is more obvious in the case of classifications based on distinctions such as normal-perverted, natural-unnatural, rational-insane, or healthy-sick. But Foucault suggests that it applies also to other, more epistemologically central distinctions such as scientific-unscientific, knowledge-error, and true-false. The ideal of a neutral standpoint transcending epochs and interests is thus a chimera.

4. Arguments for relativism

Relativism is the radical offspring of non-realism, which is itself descended from the idealism of Berkeley and Kant. Non-realism holds that we cannot meaningfully talk about they way things are independent of our experience of them: to use Michael Dummett’s formulation, what makes a statement true is not independent of our procedures for deciding it is true. The main argument in favour of non-realism is essentially negative: it avoids the difficulties endemic to metaphysical realism (a.k.a. “objectivism” or “absolutism”).

Realists hold that our judgments are true when they accurately describe or correspond to a reality that exists independently of our perceptions, conceptions, theories or desires. On this view, a true statement such as “water contains oxygen” describes a fact about this independent reality. It rests on a scientific model that may be said to “carve nature at the joints”. But an obvious question arises: how can we determine that our judgments are true in this sense? The obvious answer is that we test them by making experiments and observations. I say it will snow today, and I test this by watching the sky. I say water contains oxygen and I confirm this by showing that one of the elements separated out by electrolysis supports combustion. When our assertions are decisively confuted by experience, we conclude that they are false—i.e. they describe a state of affairs that does not obtain.

Relativists accept that this is how we normally conceive of truth and falsity—in ordinary usage, the word “true” means something like “corresponds to the facts”–and as an account of our everyday epistemic procedures it is unobjectionable. But they argue that it loses coherence if it is elevated to the metaphysical level. For what is really happening, even when we are confirming the most mundane belief about the empirical world, is that we are satisfying ourselves that this belief coheres with our other beliefs. We confirm that the sea is salty by tasting it or by conducting a chemical analysis of seawater. But these procedures only confirm our belief about sea water in the sense of showing it to be compatible with or even entailed by a host of other beliefs: for instance, that the sample we are examining is typical; that nothing else tastes quite like salt; that our sensory faculties are trustworthy on this occasion; that salt tastes roughly the same at different times. What we can never do, argue relativists and other non-realists, is check the degree of correspondence between our judgments and reality as it is independent of our experience of it. To do this we would have to take a “sideways on” view of the cognitive relation between subject and object. But this is impossible since any vantage point we adopt will necessarily be that of the subject. For the same reason, we cannot compare our overall conceptual scheme or theoretical model of reality with reality as it is “in itself.”

The driving idea behind empiricism and the upshot of Kant’s critique of speculative metaphysics is thus that concepts must be tied to experience if they are to have legitimate employment in science or philosophy. Relativists argue that the metaphysical realist’s concept of truth fails this test, for it takes the notion of “correspondence with reality” out of its everyday employment, where it is genuinely useful, and tries to press it into metaphysical service, where it is neither useful nor legitimate. So even if, in its normal usage, “truth” means something like correspondence with reality, the ultimate criterion of truth turns out to be coherence with other beliefs. To put it another way: our philosophical conception of truth cannot simply be an expanded version of our commonsense notion of truth as correspondence. And this implies that truth must always be relative to some belief system, to some particular epistemic standpoint. This is the first of the two theses identified above as constituting the doctrinal kernel of relativism. Numerous philosophers have affirmed it. Yet many of these have sought to avoid relativism by rejecting the second thesis—that no standpoint is metaphysically privileged over all others.

This second thesis is what gives relativism its bad name. Critics commonly reduce it to the claim that any point of view is as good as any other and then attack it with some variation of Plato’s arguments against Protagoras. But virtually no well-known philosophers actually hold that all standpoints are of equal worth. Richard Rorty, for instance, who is widely regarded as a relativist, dismisses that position as “silly.” (Richard Rorty, Objectivism, Relativism, and Truth, p. 89). Rorty, Kuhn and most other relativists accept that one can have cogent reasons for preferring one standpoint to another; the preferred point of view may, for instance, exhibit greater logical consistency or greater predictive power than other available perspectives. But they argue that such reasons cannot confer any special metaphysical status on the standpoint in question. They cannot, for instance, show it to be the one favoured by God, or dictated by Reason, or most in accord with human nature.

Relativists typically justify this conclusion along the following lines. Any proof of a standpoint’s superiority must rest on premises that express fundamental assumptions and basic values. For instance, arguments for the superiority of the standpoint of modern science over that of religion will presuppose the value of consistency, of solving theoretical puzzles, and of being able to manipulate one’s environment. A person who defends the literal truth of the bible but shares these values is likely to be persuaded fairly quickly by these arguments. But a person who holds that truth appears to humans as paradoxical, and who values tradition and religious faith over experimental evidence and predictive power will not be persuaded. An argument can only be convincing to one who accepts its premises. Some premises, though, like those just mentioned, are so fundamental that they are not usually argued for at all. Rather, they are constitutive of a particular outlook.

The relativists’ thesis is not that one cannot support standpoints with arguments; it is that in the end all such arguments must be circular since they inevitably rest on premises that are themselves part of the standpoint. Critics will here point out that there is a difference between denying that the superiority of one standpoint over all others can be proved and denying that such a standpoint exists. In reply, relativists are likely to claim that this distinction is an abstract one that no consistent empiricist or pragmatist would make. To insist that one standpoint is objectively superior to all others, they argue, even though there is no way of proving this, is dogmatic and pointless; to claim that one’s own standpoint enjoys this unique but undemonstrable superiority is dogmatic and implausible.

A critic might also object that what relativists call “cogent” reasons for preferring one standpoint to another are not epistemically relevant: that is, they do not provide grounds for thinking that the standpoint generates or ensures beliefs that are objectively true. But this is clearly a point most relativists would be willing to concede. The notion of objective truth referred to here is not a concept for which they have a use, preferring instead something like William James’ conception of truth as “what is good in the way of belief.”

5. Objections to relativism

Critics of relativism are legion, but the objections leveled against it are usually of two kinds, both pioneered by Plato in his critique of Protagoras. One line of attack tries to show that relativism is incoherent because it is self-refuting. The other common objection is that relativism, if taken seriously, would have bad practical consequences. Let us consider both of these in turn.

a. Relativism is Self-Refuting

A doctrine is self-refuting if its truth implies its falsehood. Relativism asserts that the truth-value of a statement is always relative to some particular standpoint. This implies that the same statement can be both true and false. The qualification that the statement is true relative to standpoint A but false relative to standpoint B may save relativism from the charge of embracing gross contradictions. But it still clearly implies that relativism itself is false, at least relative to some standpoints. One might say that it is just as much false as it is true, in which case there seems to be no good reason to prefer relativism to alternative positions such as realism.

One possible response to this objection would be to modify the theory and hold that all truths are relative except for the truth that all truths are relative. On this view, the relativist thesis enjoys a unique status, being true in some non-relativistic sense. This position may be coherent, but it is rather implausible. It is hard to see what could justify granting the thesis of relativism this exceptional status. A more plausible option is for relativists to concede that their view is false relative to at least some non-relativistic theoretical frameworks but to deny that this admission is damaging. Relativism, they can claim, is simply in the same situation as any other theory. The theory of evolution is true from the perspective of modern science and false from the perspective of Christian fundamentalism. Relativists deny that one of these perspectives is demonstrably better than the other. But this does not mean that they cannot affirm the scientific perspective, and do so for cogent reasons. In the same way, they can acknowledge that relativism is false from the standpoint of metaphysical realism; but they can do this without inconsistency or incoherence since they are not metaphysical realists, and they have reasons for preferring relativism to realism.

A variation on the charge that relativism is self-refuting is the argument that it is somehow self-refuting for relativists to assert or to argue for their position. This line of attack has been pressed forcefully by Hilary Putnam and others. Putnam’s argument is that ordinary rational discourse presupposes a non-relativistic notion of truth. Jûrgen Habermas offers a similar sort of argument in his critique of postmodernists like Foucault and Derrida, claiming that a commitment to truth, like a commitment to sincerity, is a necessary condition of successful communication.

Relativists, however, are likely to remain skeptical about these alleged presuppositions and implicit commitments. It may be true that when we engage in rational discourse we implicitly commit ourselves to the truth of what we are saying. But it is not at all obvious that we implicitly commit ourselves to a non-relativistic conception of truth. And even if this were the case, it is not clear why this supposed presupposition of everyday communication should be accorded so much respect and made the basis for a philosophical account of truth. Our everyday notions of space and time may also be non-relativistic, but we do not demand that physicists’ theories of space and time conform to our pre-scientific ideas.

b. Relativism has Pernicious Consequences

This criticism also was first ventured by Plato and continues to be endorsed by many. Cognitive relativism is thought to undermine our commitment to improving our ways of thinking rather as moral relativism is thought to undermine our belief in the possibility of moral progress. Several reasons have been given to support this anxiety. To some, the fact that relativism countenances the possibility of multiple true but incompatible points of view entails a kind of epistemic nihilism. If creationism and the theory of evolution, Ptolemaic and Copernican astronomy, astrology and modern psychology are all equally true, then what purpose is served by developing new scientific theories? All views are of equal value, so why not just rest content with whatever happens to be “true for us”?

Against this, relativists can offer two responses. First, truth is not the only epistemic value. We can also prefer theories on the basis of such values as coherence with our other beliefs, predictive power, and practical fruitfulness. Second, by endorsing relativism one does not lose the right to judge beliefs according to their truth or falsity. Modern relativists will believe that the earth orbits the sun and that Copernicus’ discovery represented scientific progress over earlier astronomy. But their philosophical account of the status of these beliefs will be relativistic. The Copernican theory is true and its acceptance represents progress according to the values and concerns that constitute the modern scientific standpoint—a standpoint shared by both relativists and non-relativists. The difference between them is that the relativists do not believe this standpoint can be proved superior to others except by arguments that are essentially circular and question-begging.

Hillary Putnam presses a slightly different version of the above objection. Relativism, he argues, tries to “naturalize” the concept of reason. What he means is that relativists try to discuss questions of truth, knowledge, and rationality in a thoroughly descriptive, non-normative way. Like social scientists afraid of allowing value-judgments to creep into their work, they take a detached stance and simply report the epistemic customs and practices of different cultures, eschewing any impulse to endorse or criticize them. And this amounts, in Putnam’s words, to “mental suicide”. For, while particular norms of rationality will be entrenched within a particular culture, reason has an inalienable critical or transcendent function which can be used to criticize existing epistemic norms. Relativism can thus be accused of encouraging a certain kind of intellectual passivity.

Relativists have also been accused of embracing determinism, and certainly thinkers like Nietzsche and Foucault sometimes invite this charge. The epistemic norms of a culture or a period are taken to be shaped by non-rational forces such as class interests, technology, or the will to power of a group or individual. And what people then come to believe is seen as a function of these norms. For example, Foucault suggests that the classification of homosexuality as a disease results from employing a certain kind of theoretical framework, one that posits a sharp distinction between the natural and the unnatural and correlates the former with the healthy, the latter with the sick. And this framework becomes established because it serves certain interests. So truth is identified with what is believed to be true, and what is believed to be true is determined by larger social forces operating within a culture or historical epoch.

This deterministic tendency, like the attempt to naturalize reason, is held by critics to entail, or at least encourage, a renunciation of the longstanding project of using reason to criticize existing norms, beliefs, and practices in order to furnish ourselves with better ones. Relativism is thus associated with the counter-Enlightenment aspects of postmodernism. But association is not the same thing as logical entailment. It may well be true that some relativists are drawn towards determinism or feel they must eschew value judgments. But it is not clear that these tendencies must be part of a relativistic outlook. Other relativists will argue that the connection between relativism and determinism, say, is historical and contingent rather than logical and necessary. In their view, one can consistently endorse a relativistic view of truth while still being committed to the relative superiority of some views over others, to the value of critical reflection, and to the possibility of using reason as an instrument of scientific and social progress.

6. Conclusion

Cognitive relativism continues to be an important but controversial position that one encounters in contemporary debates about the nature of truth, knowledge, rationality, and science. These debates can sometimes be confusing because people neither agree about exactly what relativism affirms, nor about whose views should be described as a relativistic.

Critics of relativism sometimes seem to assume that relativists are denying that they believe—or denying themselves the right to believe—obvious truths. But the more sophisticated relativists do not deny that statements like “the earth is round” are true. They just favour a certain philosophical account of what is involved and implied when we describe such statements as “true”. The situation here is reminiscent of the debate between idealists and some of their materialist critics. The critics charge idealists like Berkeley with holding that our sense perceptions are illusions, and they think they can refute this doctrine by doing things like kicking stones. But the idealists do not see themselves as holding or implying any such view. They just think that the materialist explanation of our sense-experiences is philosophically problematic; so they offer what they take to be a more coherent alternative.

On the other hand, relativism is sometimes advanced quite crudely. Then, instead of being a philosophical view about the status of our beliefs and the limitations on how we might support these beliefs, it becomes an excuse for accepting uncritically one’s own culture’s assumptions and epistemic norms; or it serves to rationalize intellectual apathy or slackness masquerading as tolerance of diverse opinions. Just as idealists still have to negotiate what we normally call the material world, so relativists have to make decisions about whether particular claims are true or false. Their philosophical relativism may incline them towards being more open-minded and tolerant than dyed-in-the-wool absolutists and objectivists. But they cannot avoid adopting specific standpoints, choosing between theories, and endorsing particular beliefs and values. At bottom, the debate over relativism is about whether it is possible for relativists to make these commitments consistently and sincerely.

7. References and Further Reading

Bernstein, Richard J. Beyond Objectivism and Relativism. Philadelphia: University of Pennsylvania Press, 1985.
Davidson, Donald. “On the Very Idea of a Conceptual Scheme.” Proceedings and Addresses of the American Philosophical Association (1974), 5-20.
Field, Hartry. “Realism and Relativism.” Journal of Philosophy 79 (1982): 553-557.
Forster, Paul D. “What Is at Stake Between Putnam and Rorty?” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research LII, No. 3 (1992): 585-603.
Foucault, Michel. Power/Knowledge: Selected Interviews and Other Writings. Edited by Colin Gordon. Translated by Colin Gordon, Leo Marshall, John Mepham, and Kate Soper. New York: Pantheon Books, 1980.
Foucault, Michel. The Foucault Reader. Edited by Paul Rabinow. New York: Pantheon Books, 1984
Gadamer, Hans-Georg. Truth and Method. Second revised edition. Translated and revised by J. Weinsheimer and D. G. Marshall. New York: Crossroad, 1989.
Gellner, E.. Relativism and the Social Sciences. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1985.
Geertz, Clifford. The Interpretation of Cultures. New York: Basic Books, 1973.
Goodman, Nelson. Ways of Worldmaking. Indianapolis: Hackett, 1978.
Habermas, Jürgen. The Theory of Communicative Action, vol. 1, Reason and the Rationalization of Society. Translated by Thomas McCarthy. Boston: Beacon Press, 1984.
Habermas, Jürgen. The Philosophical Discourse of Modernity. Translated by Frederick Lawrence. Cambridge, Mass.: M.I.T. Press, 1987.
Hollis, Martin and Lukes, Steven (eds). Rationality and Relativism. Cambridge, Mass.: The M.I.T. Press, 1982.
Jackson Ronald Lee. “Cultural Imperialism or Benign Relativism? A Putnam-Rorty Debate.” International Philosophical Quarterly XXVIII, No. 4, Issue 112 (1988).
Jarvie, I. C. Rationality and Relativism: In search of a philosophy and history of anthropology. London: Routledge & Kegan Paul, 1984.
Johnson Jeffery L. “Making Noises in Counterpoint or Chorus: Putnam’s Rejection of Relativism.” Erkenntnis 34 (1991): 323-345.
Kelly, Michael, ed. Critique and Power: Recasting the Foucault/Habermas Debate. Cambridge, Mass.: M.I.T. Press, 1994.
Krausz, Michael, and Meiland, Jack W., eds. Relativism: Cognitive and Moral. Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press, 1982.
Krausz, Michael. Relativism: Conflicts and confrontations. Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press, 1989.
Kuhn Thomas S. The Structure of Scientific Revolutions, 2nd Edition. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1970.
MacIntyre, Alasdair. “Relativism, Power, and Philosophy.” Proceedings and Addresses of the American Philosophical Association. Newark, Delaware: APA (1985): 5-22.
Plato, Theaetetus. Translated by M. J. Levett, revised by Myles Burnyeay. Indianapolis: Hackett, 1990.
Preston, John. “On Some Objections to Relativism.” Ratio 5, No. 1 (1992): 57-73.
Putnam, Hilary. Reason, Truth and History. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1981.
Putnam, Hilary. Realism and Reason: Philoosophical Papers, Volume 3. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1983.
Putnam, Hilary. The Many Faces of Realism. La Salle, Illinois: Open Court, 1987.
Quine, Willard Van Orman. Ontological Relativity and Other Essays. New York: Columbia University Press, 1969.
Rorty, Richard. Consequences of Pragmatism. Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press, 1982.
Rorty, Richard. Contingency, irony, and solidarity. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1989.
Rorty, Richard. Objectivity, relativism, and truth: Philosophical papers, Volume 1. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1991.
Rorty, Richard. Truth and Progress: Philosophical Papers, Volume 3. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1998.
Scheffler, Israel. Science and Subjectivity. Indianapolis: Bobbs-Merrill, 1967.
Solomon Miriam. “On Putnam’s argument for the inconsistency of relativism.” The Southern Journal of Philosophy XXVIII, No. 2 (1990): 213-220.
Throop, William M. “Relativism and Error: Putnam’s Lessons for the Relativist.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 49 (1989): 675-678.
Westacott, Emrys. “Relativism, Truth, and Implicit Commitments.” International Studies in Philosophy 32:2 (2000(: 95-126.
Whorf, Benjamin Lee. Language, Thought and Reality. Cambridge, Mass.: M.I.T. Press, 1956.
Winch, Peter. The Idea of a Social Science and its Relation to Philosophy. London: Routeldge & Kegan Paul, 1958.
Wilson, Bryan. Rationality. Oxford: Basil Blackwell, 1970.
Wittgenstein, Ludwig. Philosophical Investigations. Translated by G. E. M. Anscombe. Oxford: Basil Blackwell, 1953.

Author Information

Emrys Westacott
Email: westacott@alfred.edu
Alfred University
U. S. A.

The Phenomenological Reduction

There is an experience in which it is possible for us to come to the world with no knowledge or preconceptions in hand; it is the experience of astonishment. The “knowing” we have in this experience stands in stark contrast to the “knowing” we have in our everyday lives, where we come to the world with theory and “knowledge” in hand, our minds already made up before we ever engage the world. However, in the experience of astonishment, our everyday “knowing,” when compared to the “knowing” that we experience in astonishment, is shown up as a pale epistemological imposter and is reduced to mere opinion by comparison.

The phenomenological reduction is at once a description and prescription of a technique that allows one to voluntarily sustain the awakening force of astonishment so that conceptual cognition can be carried throughout intentional analysis, thus bringing the “knowing” of astonishment into our everyday experience. It is by virtue of the “knowing” perspective generated by the proper performance of the phenomenological reduction that phenomenology claims to offer such a radical standpoint on the world phenomenon; indeed, it claims to offer a perspective that is so radical, it becomes the standard of rigor whereby every other perspective is judged and by which they are grounded. In what follows there will be close attention paid to correctly understanding the rigorous nature of the phenomenological reduction, the epistemological problem that spawned it, how that problem is solved by the phenomenological reduction, and the truly radical nature of the technique itself.

In other words, the phenomenological reduction is properly understood as a regimen designed to transform a philosopher into a phenomenologist by virtue of the attainment of a certain perspective on the world phenomenon. The path to the attainment of this perspective is a species of meditation, requiring rigorous, persistent effort and is no mere mental exercise. It is a species of meditation because, unlike ordinary meditation, which involves only the mind, this more radical form requires the participation of the entire individual and initially brings about a radical transformation of the individual performing it similar to a religious conversion. Husserl discovered the need for such a regimen once it became clear to him that the foundation upon which scientific inquiry rested was compromised by the very framework of science itself and the psychological assumptions of the scientist; the phenomenological reduction is the technique whereby the phenomenologist puts him or herself in a position to provide adequately rigorous grounds for scientific or any other kind of inquiry.

Introduction
Historical Background of the Phenomenological Reduction
1. Husserl’s Early Works
2. Husserl’s Later Works
The Epistemological Problem the Phenomenological Reduction Aims to Solve
The Analysis That Disclosed the Need for the Reduction
1. The Self-Refutation of the Sciences
2. The Reduction Prefigured
The Structure, Nature and Performance of the Phenomenological Reduction
How the Reduction Solves the Epistemological Problem
1. The Problem of Constitution
2. The Reduction and the Theme of Philosophy
References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

The phenomenological reduction is the meditative practice described by Edmund Husserl, the founder of phenomenology, whereby one, as a phenomenologist, is able to liberate oneself from the captivation in which one is held by all that one accepts as being the case. According to Husserl, once one is liberated from this captivation-in-an-acceptedness, one is able to view the world as a world of essences, free from any contamination that presuppositions of conceptual framework or psyche might contribute. Many have variously misunderstood the practice of the phenomenological reduction, not in the sense that what they are doing is wrong, but in the sense that they do not take what they do far enough; this article will acquaint the reader with the extent to which Husserl and Fink’s original account intended the performance of the reduction to be taken.

The procedure of the phenomenological reduction emerges in Husserl’s thought as a necessary requirement of the solution he proposed to a problem that he, himself, had raised with respect to the adequacy of the foundation upon which scientific inquiry rests. Thus, if we are ever to achieve an appropriate level of appreciation for the procedure of the phenomenological reduction, we must begin by acquainting ourselves with the role that Husserl sees it playing in his overall project of giving the sciences an adequate epistemological foundation. This problem of the foundation of scientific inquiry spans Husserl’s entire career from his early to later work; we see its beginning arguments in Logical Investigations, one of his earlier works, and we also see it playing a prominent role later in his career as it dominates one of his latest works, The Crisis of European Sciences and Transcendental Phenomenology. Accordingly, this article will take as themes for its major divisions: 1) the historical background of the phenomenological reduction, 2) Husserl’s analysis of the foundation of scientific inquiry that demonstrates a need for the phenomenological reduction, and 3) The Structure, Nature, and Performance of the Phenomenological Reduction.

The section on the historical background of the phenomenological reduction will serve to show that this procedure does not arrive as “a bolt out of the blue,” as it were; rather, it appears as the logically required solution to a specific problem. The problem that it addresses is the problem of the adequacy of the foundations of scientific inquiry. To illustrate Husserl’s misgivings with the foundations of scientific inquiry, consider the logical relationship between the axioms of geometry and its theorems and proofs. The point of doing proofs in geometry is to show that each theorem of geometry is adequately grounded in the axioms, that which is taken as being “given” in geometry. In scientific inquiry, what scientists take as being given is the natural world and the things in that world; consequently, those things and the world itself are never questioned but taken to be the logical bedrock upon which the subsequent scientific investigations are based. In other words, scientists take the world to be their axioms; and it is this axiomatic status that Husserl throws into question when he shows that the results of scientific investigation are a function of both the architectonics of scientific hypotheses and the psychological coloring of the investigating scientist. For this reason, Husserl says that if we are ever to be able to access the pure world so that it can act as a proper foundation, we must strip away both of these qualifications and return to the “things themselves” [die Sache selbst]. That is, we must return to the world as it is before it is contaminated by either the categories of scientific inquiry or the psychological assumptions of the scientist. The phenomenological reduction is the technique whereby this stripping away occurs; and the technique itself has two moments: the first Husserl names epoché, using the Greek term for abstention, and the second is referred to as the reduction proper, an inquiring back into consciousness.

2. Historical Background of the Phenomenological Reduction

a. Husserl’s Early Works

Since the main burden of this article lies in the specific area of the phenomenological reduction, it is not necessary to go into great detail regarding Husserl’s early work beyond noting that it dealt almost exclusively with mathematics and logic; and that it is the ground out of which his later thought grew. In his Philosophy of Arithmetic (1891), Husserl questions the psychological origin of basic arithmetical concepts such as unity, multiplicity, and number; a project that he pursues later into the Prolegomena to the Logical Investigations. In the former work, Husserl gives us an analysis of the origin of the authentic concept of number, i.e., number to be conceived intuitionally. It is here that Husserl pays special attention to the question of the foundation of abstraction for the basic arithmetical concepts. Thus, we find that Husserl’s early efforts at providing a subjective complement to objective logic led him to investigate the general a priori of correlation of cognition, of the sense of cognition and the object of cognition, and led him also to conceive an absolute science designed as a universal analysis of constitution in which the origins of objectivity in transcendental subjectivity are elucidated.

A crucial element of Husserl’s early work in the Philosophy of Arithmetic is his critique of psychologism; it is this critique that is continued in his Logical Investigations and which sets the stage for the emancipation of the formal-logical objects and laws from psychological determinations, as was the then-current view. However, this liberation was not Husserl’s ultimate goal, but merely the preparatory work for understanding the connection between pure logic and concrete (psychical, or rather phenomenological) processes of thinking, between ideal conditions of cognition and temporally individuated acts of thinking.

b. Husserl’s Later Works

It is owing to this goal that Husserl’s later work moves quickly away from the strictly logical and mathematical character of his early work and takes on the more transcendental character of his later work. Thus, the trend of Husserl’s thought moves from his critique of the psychologistic account of mathematical and logical objects to transcendental subjectivity by means of his persistent questioning of the foundation of knowledge. It is important to note that his questioning of the foundation of knowledge is not the same as the quest for certainty that characterizes much of modernist thought—to which some philosophers believe Husserl’s American contemporary, John Dewey in his The Quest for Certainty, presented successful objections. Rather, Husserl’s quest was not for certainty but for the founding of the conditions for the possibility of knowledge. That is, he was not searching for an answer to the question: How do we know the tree is in the quad? He was seeking an answer to the question: How does it come about that consciousness can make contact with the tree in the quad? This is what was meant above when mention was made that Husserl’s ultimate goal was to understand the connection between pure logic and concrete processes of thinking.

In his dogged pursuit of an answer to this question, Husserl is pushed from the then current psychological theory to the object; from the object back to consciousness, and finally all the way back to transcendental consciousness and the emergence of the “ultimate question of phenomenology” regarding the phenomenology of phenomenology. It is this question of the phenomenology of phenomenology that dominates the inquiry into the nature of the phenomenological reduction that we find in Sixth Cartesian Meditation and in the articles that Eugen Fink wrote around 1933 and 1934 in his attempt to further explain the phenomenological philosophy of Edmund Husserl. However, what we need is a more finely tuned elucidation of the epistemological problem that was the initial impetus driving Husserl’s early efforts.

3. The Epistemological Problem the Phenomenological Reduction Aims to Solve

The prevailing epistemology in Husserl’s time was a neo-Kantian position; indeed, it was owing to the criticism brought against phenomenology by this cadre of philosophers that Eugen Fink was constrained to publish his very important article, “The Phenomenological Philosophy of Edmund Husserl and Contemporary Criticism” in the journal, Kant-Studien; Fink uses the locution “contemporary criticism” in his title as a euphemism for “neo-Kantians.” Roughly put, the Kantian epistemological model is one that strives to ameliorate the stark contrast between the position Descartes put forward and the one brought about by the criticism of his position in the writings of Locke, Berkeley, and Hume, to name a few; that is, Kant’s position is one that seeks an irenic modulation between the rationalists and the empiricists. Kant’s epistemology, however conciliatory toward each camp, still leaned heavily on certain aspects of Descartes’ thought; notably, the distinction between consciousness and object (mind and body), albeit in Kant’s terms this distinction was taken up as a distinction between a noumenal world and a phenomenal world—a difference that Kant bridged by means of the categories. The categories themselves were arrived at by asking the question: what would have to be the case in order for our experience of the world to be as it is? This question is commonly referred to as the question determining the conditions for the possibility of experience and more specifically as the Transcendental Deduction.

Husserl’s epistemological insight is that there is no such distinction between consciousness and object, as had been assumed by Descartes and subsequently taken up in a slightly different form by Kant. In Husserl’s thought, the terms “noesis” and “noema” do not so much identify distinct items set over against each other (e.g. consciousness and object) as much as they provide a linguistic vehicle to speak about the interpenetration of each by the other as aspects of a more inclusive whole, the Life-world—understood in its broadest sense. A key point made by Fink in his article for the neo-Kantians is that when we think of the world, it is always a world already containing us thinking it; this fact is overlooked by the Kantian picture of the world; a picture which assumes a perspective that is neither consciousness nor world but which sets each over against the other. For Kant, this imagined perspective is what gives us access to the distinction between the noumenal and phenomenal worlds; ironically, it is also this perspective that makes the transcendental deduction necessary, since the distinction between noumenal and phenomenal is a state of affairs to which we do not have direct access and must, of necessity, deduce it.

Husserl constructs his epistemological position by first noticing the very obvious fact that all consciousness is consciousness of something; and it is this insight that establishes the relationship between the noesis and noema. If knowledge is ever to be established at all, it must be established in consciousness; the epistemological problem, then, for Husserl is to describe consciousness, since without consciousness, no knowledge is possible. Or, to put a more Kantian spin on it, consciousness itself is the condition for the possibility of knowledge. Furthermore, since we are always already in a world, the first task of epistemology is to properly and accurately describe what is already the case; and we can do this only if we begin with a thorough examination of consciousness itself and carry that examination all the way back to the “I” in the “I Am.” Husserl speaks of going “back” [ruckfrage] because we must begin where we are; and where we are includes a sense of self whose identity is temporarily seated in the sedimented layers of consciousness built up through our temporal experiences. Hence, if we are to encounter the “I” we must dig back down through those layers or we must continually present ourselves with the question: who is “I”? as we consider the great variety of things with which we have identified. This questioning back is the method of the phenomenological reduction and aims to lay bare the “I”—the condition for the possibility of knowledge.

It is important to keep in mind that Husserl’s phenomenology did not arise out of the questioning of an assumption in the same way that much of the history of thought has progressed; rather, it was developed, as so many discoveries are, pursuant to a particular experience, namely, the experience of the world and self that one has if one determinedly seeks to experience the “I”; and, Hume notwithstanding, such an experience is possible.

4. The Analysis That Disclosed the Need for the Reduction

Although it is generally conceded that Husserl’s thought underwent a significant transformation from his early interests in logic and mathematics, as indicated in his “On the Concept of Number” and his Philosophy of Arithmetic, to his later transcendental interests, as indicated by The Crisis of European Sciences and Transcendental Phenomenology, the actual “turning point” is not so generally accepted. This is due, in part, to the fact that Husserl’s work can be viewed developmentally both according to the chronological appearance of his work and according to its systematic connections. Thus, the “development” of his thought can be seen either in terms of his published work, i.e., chronologically, or in terms of key systematic methodological concepts. Viewed chronologically, Bernet, Kern, and Marbach (Bernet, 1989) put the beginning of the split around 1915-1917, the last years Husserl spent at Göttingen, but is only clearly seen in the early years of Husserl’s teaching at Freiburg (around 1917-1921) (p.1); but considered systematically, they say that the partition relates to the consistent extension of the research program of phenomenological philosophy towards a genetic-explanatory phenomenology as a supplement to the hitherto carried-out static-descriptive phenomenology (p.1). The terms “static,” “genetic,” and “generative” phenomenology refer to aspects of phenomenology that come into play after the reduction has been performed; however, they articulate distinctions that must be kept clearly in mind when evaluating phenomenological analyses.

In the early phases of his thinking, Husserl was concerned chiefly with the phenomenological-descriptive analysis of specific types of experiences and their correlates as well as with describing general structures of consciousness; he also aimed at the foundation and elaboration of the corresponding methodology (phenomenological reflection, reduction, and eidetics) (p.1). Similarly in the later phases of his thought, there is the attempt by means of genetic phenomenology to elucidate the concrete unification of experiencing in the personal ego and in the transcendental community of egos, or monads, as well as in the constitution of the correlative surrounding worlds and of the one world common to all (p.2).

For the purposes of tracing the development of the phenomenological reduction, I take the relevant period of the transformation of Husserl’s thought from early to late to be between 1900 and 1913; the two volumes of Logical Investigations were published in 1900 and 1901 but it wasn’t until the appearance of The Idea of Phenomenology in 1907 that many of the characteristic themes of phenomenology were explicitly articulated. This little volume was soon followed by the publication of “Philosophy as Rigorous Science” in 1911; and that by the publication of Ideas I in 1913, where the most explicit treatment, up to that time, of the main phenomenological themes is given.

a. The Self-Refutation of the Sciences

In order to grasp the full import of the move that Husserl makes to phenomenology, we must understand the arguments that motivate that move; and we get a glimpse of those arguments in his “Philosophy as Rigorous Science” published in 1911. In that article, Husserl’s chief aim is epistemological and expresses itself first as a critique of the natural sciences and psychology and then as an adumbration of a technique that later, in 1913 with the publication of Ideen I, would be termed the “epoché ” or the “reduction.”

Husserl begins his critique of the natural sciences by noting certain absurdities that become evident when such naturalism is adopted in an effort to “naturalize” consciousness and reason; these absurdities are both theoretical and practical. Husserl says that when “the formal-logical principles, the so-called ‘laws of thought,’ are interpreted by naturalism as natural laws of thinking,” there occurs a kind of “inevitable” absurdity owing to an inherent inconsistency involved in the naturalist position. His claim in this article alludes to the more fully formed argument from volume 1 of his Logical Investigations (Husserl, 1970), which will be summarized here.

The natural sciences are empirical sciences and, as such, deal only with empirical facts. Thus, when the formal-logical principles are subsumed under the “laws of Nature” as “laws of thought,” this makes the “law of thought” just one among many of the empirical laws of nature. However, Husserl notes that “the only way in which a natural law can be established and justified, is by induction from the singular facts of experience” (p.99). Furthermore, induction does not establish the holding of the law, “only the greater or lesser probability of its holding; the probability, and not the law, is justified by insight” (p.99). This means that logical laws must, without exception, rank as mere probabilities; yet, as he then notes, “nothing, however, seems plainer than that the laws of ‘pure logic’ all have a priori validity” (p.99). That is to say, the laws of ‘pure logic’ are established and justified, not by induction, but by apodictic inner evidence; insight justifies their truth itself. Thus, as Husserl remarks in “Philosophy as a Rigorous Science” (1965) that “naturalism refutes itself” (p.80). It is this theoretical absurdity that leads to a similar absurdity in practice.

The absurdity in practice, says Husserl, becomes apparent when we notice that the naturalist is “dominated by the purpose of making scientifically known whatever is genuine truth, the genuinely beautiful and good; he wants to know how to determine what is its universal essence and the method by which it is to be obtained in the particular case” (pp.80-81). Thus, the naturalist believes that through natural science and through a philosophy based on the same science the goal has been attained; but, says Husserl, the naturalist is going on presuppositions; indeed, to the extent that he theorizes at all, it is just to that extent “that he objectively sets up values to which value judgments are to correspond, and likewise in setting up any practical rules according to which each one is to be guided in his willing and in his conduct” (p.81). It is this state of affairs that drives Husserl to the observation that the naturalist is “idealist and objectivist in the way he acts”; since both of these cannot be true at the same time, the naturalist is involved in an absurdity (p.80).

Husserl claims that the natural scientist is not outwardly aware of these absurdities owing to the fact that he “naturalizes reason” and, on this account, is blinded by prejudice. He adds, “One who sees only empirical science will not be particularly disturbed by absurd consequences that cannot be proved empirically to contradict facts of nature” (pp.81-82). This is not to say that Husserl is arguing against science as such, to the contrary, he says that there is “in all modern life no more powerfully, more irresistibly progressing idea than that of science” and that “with regard to its legitimate aims, it is all-embracing. Looked upon in its ideal perfection, it would be reason itself, which could have no other authority equal or superior to itself” (p.82). The problem is that naturalism, which wanted to establish philosophy both on a basis of strict science and as a strict science, appears completely discredited along with its method. To this point in the argument, Husserl has simply shown that the foundation upon which scientific inquiry rests is self-contradictory and fails to offer adequate grounding. So, if the natural scientist cannot provide us with a “rigorous science” then what is needed and to whom can we look?

b. The Reduction Prefigured

Husserl’s idea is that the problems belonging to the domain of a “strict science,” namely, theoretical, axiological, and practical problems, give us a clue themselves as to the method required for their solution. He says, “through a clarification of the problems and through penetration into their pure sense, the methods adequate to these problems, because demanded by their very essence, must impose themselves on us” (p.83). It is for this reason that the refutation of naturalism based on its consequences that he just finished accomplishes very little for him, what is important is the principiant critique of the foundations of naturalism; and by this he means that he wants to direct a critical analysis at the philosophy that believes “it has definitely attained the rank of an exact science” (p.84). So what Husserl will be putting to the test is the relative strength of the term “exact” when it is used in this context. It is not the case that Husserl thinks that a science of nature does not produce important results; he thinks it does. The problem, as Husserl sees it, is that a science of nature is inadequate if it is not ultimately grounded in a strictly scientific philosophy. Husserl is not criticizing the results of science (the structural design and dignity of the house that science built) but only the foundation upon which those results rest.

With respect to the foundation, Husserl says that all natural science is naïve in regard to its point of departure because the nature that it investigates “is for it simply there.” In other words, the things that natural science investigates are its foundation because they mark the point of departure for natural science. These things are simply taken for granted uncritically as being there and “it is the aim of natural science to know these unquestioned data in an objectively valid, strictly scientific manner” (p.85). The same holds true for psychology in its domain of consciousness. It is the task of psychology “to explore this psychic element scientifically within the psychophysical nexus of nature, to determine it in an objectively valid way, to discover the laws according to which it develops and changes, comes into being and disappears” (p.86). Even where psychology, as an empirical science, concerns itself with determinations of bare events of consciousness and not with dependencies that are psychophysical, “those events are thought of, nevertheless, as belonging to nature, that is, as belonging to human or brute consciousnesses that for their part have an unquestioned and co-apprehended connection with human and brute organisms” (p.86). Thus, he states that “every psychological judgment involves the existential positing of physical nature, whether expressly or not” (p.86).

This uncritical acceptance is also reflected in the naïveté that characterizes natural science since at every place in its procedure it accepts nature as given and relies upon it when it performs experiments. Thus, ultimately, every method of experiential science leads back precisely to experience. But isolated experience is of no worth to science; rather, “it is in the methodical disposition and connection of experiences, in the interplay of experience and thought which has its rigid logical laws, that valid experience is distinguished from invalid, that each experience is accorded its level of validity, and that objectively valid knowledge as such, knowledge of nature, is worked out” (p.87). Although this critique of experience is satisfactory, says Husserl, as long as we remain within natural science and think according to its point of view, a completely different critique of experience is still possible and indispensable. It is a critique that places in question all experience as such as well as the sort of thinking proper to empirical science (p.87).

For Husserl, this is a critique that raises questions such as: “how can experience as consciousness give or contact an object? How can experiences be mutually legitimated or corrected by means of each other, and not merely replace each other or confirm each other subjectively? How can the play of a consciousness whose logic is empirical make objectively valid statements, valid for things that are in and for themselves? Why are the playing rules, so to speak, of consciousness not irrelevant for things?” It is by means of these questions that Husserl hopes to highlight his major concern of how it is that natural science can be comprehensible in every case, “to the extent that it pretends at every step to posit and to know a nature that is in itself—in itself in opposition to the subjective flow of consciousness” (p.88). He says that these questions become riddles as soon as reflection upon them becomes serious and that epistemology has been the traditional discipline to which these questions were referred, but epistemology has not answered the call in a manner “scientifically clear, unanimous, and decisive.”

To Husserl, this all points to the absurdity of a theory of knowledge that is based on any psychological theory of knowledge. He punctuates this claim by noting that if certain riddles are inherent, in principle, to natural science, then “it is self-evident that the solution of these riddles according to premises and conclusions in principle transcends natural science.” He adds that “to expect from natural science itself the solution of any one of the problems inherent in it as such—thus inhering through and through, from beginning to end—or even merely to suppose that it could contribute to the solution of such a problem any premises whatsoever, is to be involved in a vicious circle” (pp.88-89).

With this being the case, it becomes clear to Husserl that every scientific, as well as every pre-scientific, application of nature “must in principle remain excluded in a theory of knowledge that is to retain its univocal sense. So, too, must all expressions that imply thetic existential positings of things in the framework of space, time, causality, etc. This obviously applies also to all existential positings with regard to the empirical being of the investigator, of his psychical faculties, and the like” (p.89). It is here, in this passage, that we see the formal beginnings of what will later be termed the “epoché ” and “reduction” in Ideen I.

Husserl is advocating a theory of knowledge that will investigate the problems of the relationship between consciousness and being in a way that excludes, not only the “thetic existential positings of things in the framework of space, time, causality, etc.,” but also the “existential positings” and “psychical faculties” of the investigator. In other words, he wants to separate the subject matter he is investigating from both the theoretical framework of science and the coloring with which any investigator might qualify it. But to do so, knowledge theory can have before its eyes “only being as the correlate of consciousness: as perceived, remembered, expected, represented pictorially, imagined, identified, distinguished, believed, opined, evaluated, etc.” And for Husserl, this means that the investigation must be directed “toward a scientific essential knowledge of consciousness, toward that which consciousness itself ‘is’ according to its essence in all its distinguishable forms” (p.89). Husserl also notes that the investigation must also be directed toward “what consciousness ‘means,’ as well as toward the different ways in which—in accord with the essence of the aforementioned forms—it intends the objective, now clearly, now obscurely, now by presenting or by presentifying, now symbolically or pictorially, now simply, now mediated in thought, now in this or that mode of attention, and so in countless other forms, and how ultimately it ‘demonstrates’ the objective as that which is ‘validly,’ ‘really’” (p.89).

To summarize, what Husserl wants to do is to provide an unshakable ground for science, so as to make it “rigorous” and “exact.” He dismisses the efforts of both science and psychology to provide such a ground owing to the fact that the “riddles” inherent in each necessarily put the solution outside of their reach. He also notes that the traditional discipline of epistemology has failed to do this and suggests that what is needed is an investigation that is directed toward “a scientific essential knowledge of consciousness, toward that which consciousness itself ‘is’ according to its essence in all its distinguishable forms.” Furthermore, this can only be done if we separate the matter in question from the qualifications imposed on it by either the theoretical framework of science or the existential “positings” of the investigator. In other words, we must return to the matters in question, as they are themselves; and the procedure whereby this is accomplished is phenomenology, specifically, the phenomenological reduction.

5. The Structure, Nature and Performance of the Phenomenological Reduction

a. The Structure of the Phenomenological Reduction

i. The Two Moments of the Phenomenological Reduction

What actually occurs when one undertakes to perform the reduction can be discerned by giving careful attention to the things Husserl and Fink have said about it; but let me first address some terminological concerns regarding two key concepts. In Sixth Cartesian Meditation (Fink, 1995), Fink tells us “epoché and the action of the reduction proper are the two internal basic moments of the phenomenological reduction, mutually required and mutually conditioned” (p.41). This passage alerts us to the fact that the locution, phenomenological reduction, denotes two separate “moments,” each of which requires and conditions the other. Thus, in speaking of “the reduction” one needs to be careful to specify whether it is the reduction proper, which is only one of the two moments, that is meant, or whether one means the entire operation of the phenomenological reduction.

Let me also draw attention to the term “moments” here because, in order to get an accurate conception and understanding of the phenomenological reduction, we must see that it is not done in two “steps.” The moments are internal logical moments and do not refer to two “steps” that one might take to conclude the procedure as one might do, for example, in waxing a floor: where the first step is to strip off the old wax and the second step is to apply the new wax; steps imply a temporal individuation that is not true of the moments of the phenomenological reduction. Husserl’s term, epoché, the negative move whereby we bracket the world, is not a “step” that we do “first” in an effort to prepare ourselves for the later “step,” reduction proper; rather, the bracketing and the move whereby we drive the self back upon itself, the reduction proper, occur together.

There were many during his day who misunderstood what Husserl and Fink were trying to communicate; and I think part of what might have contributed to this misunderstanding is that Husserl’s readers thought that the reduction was a “two-step” process conducted wholly within the realm of the mind or imagination, not requiring any other kind of bodily participation.

1) The Epoché

Husserl’s insight is that we live our lives in what he terms a “captivation-in-an-acceptedness;” that is to say, we live our lives in an unquestioning sort of way by being wholly taken up in the unbroken belief-performance of our customary life in the world. We take for granted our bodies, the culture, gravity, our everyday language, logic and a myriad other facets of our existence. All of this together is present to every individual in every moment and makes up what Fink terms “human immanence”; everyone accepts it and this acceptance is what keeps us in captivity. The epoché is a procedure whereby we no longer accept it. Hence, Fink notes in Sixth Cartesian Meditation: “This self consciousness develops in that the onlooker that comes to himself in the epoché reduces ‘bracketed’ human immanence by explicit inquiry back behind the acceptednesses in self-apperception that hold regarding humanness, that is, regarding one’s belonging to the world; and thus he lays bare transcendental experiential life and the transcendental having of the world” (p.40). Husserl has referred to this variously as “bracketing” or “putting out of action” but it boils down to the same thing, we must somehow come to see ourselves as no longer of this world, where “this world” means to capture all that we currently accept.

At this point it may prove prudent to head off some possible misunderstandings with respect to the epoché. Perhaps the most frequent error made with respect to the epoché is made in regards to its role in the abstention of belief in the world. Here it is important to realize two things: the first is that withdrawal of belief in the world is not a denial of the world. It should not be considered that the abstention of belief in the world’s existence is the same as the denial of its existence; indeed, the whole point of the epoché is that it is neither an affirmation nor a denial in the existence of the world. In fact, says Fink, “the misunderstanding that takes the phenomenological epoché to be a straightforwardly thematic abstention from belief (instead of understanding it as transcendentally reflective!) not only has the consequence that we believe we have to fear the loss of the thematic field, but is also intimately connected with a misunderstanding of the reductive return to constituting consciousness” (p.43). The second thing has to do with who it is that is doing the abstaining and this directly concerns the moment of the reduction proper.

2) The Reduction Proper

The second moment of the phenomenological reduction is what Fink terms the “reduction proper;” he says, “under the concept of ‘action of reduction proper’ we can understand all the transcendental insights in which we blast open captivation-in-an-acceptedness and first recognize the acceptedness as an acceptedness in the first place” (p.41). If the epoché is the name for whatever method we use to free ourselves from the captivity of the unquestioned acceptance of the everyday world, then the reduction is the recognition of that acceptance as an acceptance. Fink adds, “abstention from belief can only be radical and universal when that which falls under disconnection by the epoché comes to be clearly seen precisely as a belief-construct, as an acceptedness.” It is the seeing of the acceptance as an acceptance that is the indication of having achieved a transcendental insight; it is transcendental precisely because it is an insight from outside the acceptedness that is holding us captive. It should be kept in mind that the “seeing” to which Fink refers is not a “knowing that” we live in captivation-in-an-acceptedness, since this can be achieved in the here and now by simply believing that Fink is telling the truth; the kind of “seeing” to which Fink refers is rather more like the kind of seeing that occurs when one discovers that the mud on the carpet was put there by oneself and not by another, as was first suspected.

Thus, as Fink points out, it is through the reductive insight into the transcendental being-sense of the world as “acceptedness” that “the radicality of the phenomenological epoché first becomes possible;” but “on the other hand, the reduction consistently performed and maintained, first gives methodic certainty to the reductive regress” (p.41). Taken together, the epoché and the reduction proper comprise the technique referred to as the phenomenological reduction; since these two moments cannot occur independently, it is easy to see how the single term, “reduction,” can come to be the term of preference to denote the whole of the phenomenological reduction.

Fink also brings out a misunderstanding relating to the reduction proper, which is that it is taken as a species of speculation: “hand in hand with this misunderstanding of the epoché goes a falsification of the sense of the action of reduction proper (the move back behind the self-objectivation of transcendental subjectivity). The latter is rejected as speculative construction, for instance when one says: in actuality the phenomenologist has no other theme than human inwardness” (p.47). To think that there is such reinterpretation or speculation is to miss the point of the reduction proper, that is, it is to miss the fact that what it does is interrogate man and the world and makes them the theme of a transcendental clarification—it is precisely the world phenomenon, or “being”, which is bracketed.

According to Fink and Husserl, the phenomenological reduction consists in these two “moments” of epoché and reduction proper; epoché is the “moment” in which we abandon the acceptedness of the world that holds us captive and the reduction proper indicates the “moment” in which we come to the transcendental insight that the acceptedness of the world is an acceptedness and not an absolute. The structure of the phenomenological reduction has belonging to it the human I standing in the natural attitude, the transcendental constituting I, and the transcendental phenomenologizing I, also called the onlooker or spectator. Fink says that “the reducing I is the phenomenological onlooker. This means he is, first, the one practicing the epoché and then the one who reduces, in the strict sense” (p.39).

Thus, it is by means of the epoché and reduction proper that the human I becomes distinguished from the constituting I; it is by abandoning our acceptance of the world that we are enabled to see it as captivating and hold it as a theme. It is from this perspective that the phenomenologist is able to see the world without the framework of science or the psychological assumptions of the individual.

b. The Nature of the Phenomenological Reduction

The phenomenological reduction is a radical, rigorous, and transformative meditative technique. To illustrate this, let me turn to comments that Fink makes in his “What Does the Phenomenology of Edmund Husserl Want to Accomplish: The Phenomenological Idea of Laying a Ground” (Fink, 1966/1972; German/English).

i. Self-Meditation Radicalized

The most important point to be made in reference to the nature of the phenomenological reduction is that it is a meditative technique and not a mere mental or imaginative technique. Furthermore, it is a self-meditation that has been radicalized. Fink introduces this in his discussion of laying a ground. He says that “the laying-of-a-ground of a philosophy is the original beginning of the philosopher himself, not with and for others but for himself alone; it is the disclosing of the ground which is capable of bearing the totality of a philosophical interpretation of the world” (p.161/11). In this passage we can plainly see that the ground of which Fink is speaking is not considered to be propositions, ideas, or anything else of that sort; rather the ground is precisely the philosopher him or herself. Thus, Fink says, “it is a fateful error to suppose that the principles, in accordance with which a ground-laying of philosophy is to proceed, would be present—transported, as it were, from the conflict of philosophers—as a normative ideal prior to and outside of philosophy” (p.161/11). Hence, regardless of “how such a ground-laying is carried out—be it as a return to the concealed, a priori law-giving of reason, or be it as a progression towards essentials, and the like—the meditation [die Besinnung], in which such a ground-laying is carried out, is always the first, fundamental decision of a philosophizing” (p.161/11).

Unless the term “meditation,” as Fink uses it in this context, springs out at one when reading it, the heart of this passage is likely to be misunderstood. Here there is a clear connection being established between some meditative practice [Besinnung] and the laying of a ground for philosophy. It is important to draw attention to this feature since we typically think of axioms or assumptions when we assay to discern the foundation of a philosophy; but Fink is making a clear break with that practice, holding instead that the first, fundamental decision of a philosophizing is “the meditation, in which a ground-laying is carried out” [“immer ist die Besinnung, in der sich eine solche Grundlegung vollzieht, die erste grundsätzliche Entscheidung eines Philosophierens.”] (p.162/11).

Fink adds to this by noting that “the commencement of the idea of laying-a-ground, which determines a philosophy, is always already the implicit (and perhaps only obscurely conscious) fore-grasp upon the system. Thus in embryonic form, the idea of the system is sketched out in the idea of laying-a-ground” (p.162/11). In other words, the idea of the ground-laying works itself out in whatever philosophy it grounds; the philosophy is itself pre-figured in the ground-laying and reflects it.

He explains this pre-figuring further by saying that, in the case of the philosophy of Husserl, the idea of the ground-laying working itself out “can, at first, be made understandable from the pathos of phenomenology, that is, from the deportment of the human existence lying at its ground” (p.162/11). Fink allows that this pathos is “in no way a specifically ‘phenomenological’ one, but is, rather, the constant pathos of every philosophy which, when taken seriously in a particular, inexorable way, must lead to phenomenology itself” (p.162/11). Indeed, this pathos is “nothing other than the world-wide storm of the passion of thinking which, extending out into the totality of entities and grasping it, subjects it to the spirit” (p.163/11). Fink is saying here that the will, as the pathos of philosophy, is “resolved to understand the world out of the spirit [die Welt aus dem Geist zu verstehen],” which does not mean the “naïve belief in a pre-given and present-at-hand ‘spiritual sense’ of the world, but solely the willingness to bring the spirit first to its realization precisely through the knowledge of the All of entities” (p.163/12).

Although this passage would seem to indicate the crassest “intellectualism,” since it seems to be saying that knowledge is the main operative process, Fink is insistent that neither the “‘rationalistically’ claimed self-certainty of the spirit” (here read Descartes), nor “the fascination with chaos” (read Nietzsche) that “all too easily is transformed into a defeatism of reason,” captures what he means. Rather, he says, “precisely in the face of chaos, standing fast against it, the philosopher ventures the spiritual conquering of the entity; he raises the claim of a radical and universal knowledge of the world” (p.164/12). If we inquire as to how it is possible that spirit can maintain itself and its claim, or whether it has itself already become a “ground experience”; whether we “Know what authentically is ‘spirit’” or what the true power of philosophizing existence is, Fink tells us: “Understanding itself in the passion of thinking, the pathos of the one who is philosophizing is cast back upon itself: it radicalizes itself into self-meditation [Selbstbesinnung], as into the way in which the spirit [der Geist] experiences itself. The phenomenological philosophy of Husserl lives in the pathos of that self-realization of the spirit [der Geist] which takes place in self-meditation” (p.164/13). Indeed, “the idea of the ground-laying of philosophy peculiar to phenomenology is the idea of the pure and persistent self meditation [der reinen und konsequenten Selbstbesinnung]” (p.164/13).

Although, as Fink notes, in the subjective mode of self-meditation, every philosophy carries out the business of laying a ground; “phenomenology is also materially grounded exclusively on self-meditation [gründet auch sachlich ausschließlich auf Selbstbesinnung]” (p.164/13). What Fink means here by using the term “exclusively” is that “from the very beginning phenomenology foregoes ever abandoning the deportment of pure self-meditation in favor of an objective deportment. It wants to be grounded solely upon the results of a radical and persistent self-meditation and to establish upon them the entirety of its philosophical system” (p. 164/13). Hence, for phenomenology, self-meditation is not a “mere subjective method for disclosing, as the ground and basis of the philosophical interpretation of the world, an objectivity sketched out in our spirit, for example, the objective essence of reason; rather it re-delineates the sole fundamental realm in which the philosophical problem of the world can arise” (p.164/13). Thus, in phenomenology “the concept of ‘ground,’ in return to which the philosophical grasping of the world realizes itself, has lost its usual ‘objective’ sense precisely through the persistent adherence to self-meditation, carried out with a certain radicalism of ‘purity,’ as the exclusive thematic source of philosophy” (p.165/13). Fink adds: “The ground, posited in the phenomenological idea of laying-a-ground, is the ‘self’ which uncovers itself only in pure self-meditation” (p.165/13-14).

The general logical form of this argument will reappear in 1954 with the publishing of The Crisis of European Sciences and Transcendental Phenomenology. There the argument is made that the sciences not only take the everyday life-world for granted, the everyday life-world is actually the ground for all that the sciences do because it is from there that they take their starting point. In a similar move of reasoning, the argument in this article is aimed at drawing attention to the obvious fact that the philosopher is always the real ground for any philosophy; and that if we wish, as it were, to ground that ground, we must embark on a procedure of self-meditation—indeed, if rigor is to be maintained, we are required to undertake such a course of action.

Of course, a number of questions immediately surround the suggestion of “self-meditation,” all of which derive from “the naïve and familiar, pre-given concept of ‘self-meditation’”; but it is precisely this concept that must be transformed, says Fink: “the dimension of philosophy can be attained only in the radical change of self-meditation from the indeterminateness of the preliminary, still unclarified concept into the determined phenomenological setting” (p.165/14). Thus, the former questions are now transformed into questions such as: How can this change be accomplished, and what must the nature of self-meditation be, such that, precisely in the thematization of the self, the question of the totality of entities is included and traced out in its fundamental solution? Fink’s response is that to this there is only one answer: “the transformation of the idea of the common self-meditation happens eo ipso in an extremely intensified taking of self-meditation seriously. The seriousness demanded here wants nothing less than to expose the spirit to a ground-experience which will bring it back into the power of the essence that is purely proper to it. In the self-meditation radicalized into the ‘phenomenological reduction,’ the spirit should accomplish a movement towards itself, should come unto itself” (p.165/14). But in what sense is this self-meditation radical?

ii. Radical, Rigorous, and Transformative

Some today have misunderstood the phenomenological reduction and it is probable that this failure to grasp what Husserl has discovered is partly owing to the radical nature of Husserl’s project being completely missed. Fink pieces together the very analysis of the reduction that is wanted here if we are ever to disabuse ourselves of the view that the reduction is nothing more than a mere incantation or formal condition—a mental exercise.

This type of misunderstanding of the nature of phenomenology is not something new; Fink himself made explicit reference to its breadth, even as late as 1934 when this article was originally published, saying: “The contemporary judgment of the phenomenological philosophy of Husserl fails, almost without exception, to recognize its true meaning” (Accomplish, p. 6). He then cites examples, noting that “Husserl is judged, admired and reproached sometimes as an eidetician and logician, at other times as a theoretician of knowledge, on the one hand, as an ontologist giving word to the ‘matters themselves,’ and, on the other hand, as an ‘Idealist.’ Thereby, every such Interpretation is capable, with moderate violence, of ‘proving’ itself from his writings. The authentic and central meaning of Edmund Husserl’s philosophy is today still unknown” (p. 6). Fink attributes this lack of authentic understanding, not to a lack of willingness to understand on the part of the community of readers, but, to the essence of phenomenology itself. So, the important question is: what is it about the essence of phenomenology that makes it so difficult for the devotee to come away with an authentic understanding of it?

According to Fink, we find the answer to this question by considering the fact that the appropriation of the true meaning of phenomenology “cannot at all come about within the horizon of our natural deportment of knowledge. Access to phenomenology demands a radical reversal of our total existence reaching into our depths, a change of every pre-scientifically-immediate comportment to world and things as well as of the disposition of our life lying at the basis of all scientific and traditionally-philosophical attitudes of knowledge” (p. 6).

Nearly everyone, who has had even a casual acquaintance with Husserl’s writings, has read something akin to this passage somewhere, claiming the radicality of what phenomenology attempts. Husserl is continually drawing our attention to the radical nature of phenomenology and how it affects all of our scientific knowledge and understanding; indeed, emphasizing how it grounds that very knowledge and understanding. The important thing to notice in regards to such passages, however, is that the misunderstanding of phenomenology arises precisely because the notions of the term “radical,” which are employed by the would-be readers as a hermeneutical guide in their efforts to come to an authentic appreciation of the practice of phenomenology, fail to capture all that Husserl intends by his use of it—and this in spite of the fact that he, time and again, tells us that his use of the term “radical” is new.

Consider, for instance, Husserl’s introduction to the Cartesian Meditations where he expounds on the need for a “radical new beginning” of philosophy saying, “to renew with greater intensity the radicalness of their spirit, the radicalness of self-responsibility, to make that radicalness true for the first time by enhancing it to the last degree…” (Cartesian Meditations, p. 6). Husserl’s emphatic demand that the radicalness become true “for the first time” indicates that his sense of “radical” is much more radical than might ordinarily be thought. Again, in Sixth Cartesian Meditation we read, “This is the problem of the proper methodological character of the phenomenological fore-knowledge that first makes it possible to pose the radical questions—in a new sense of ‘radical’—, to provide the motive for performing the phenomenological reduction” (Sixth, p. 36). Here we see an explicit mention of the fact that the term “radical” is being employed in a “new” sense.

Thus, when some of misunderstand the reduction, they, most probably, are not taking seriously Husserl’s claim of radicality, i.e., they have not understood exactly how extreme Husserl’s sense of the term is. If they, however, take a close look at Fink’s development and analysis of phenomenology in this article and by pay close attention to the intensity of the language he uses in relation to it, we can remedy this deficiency quite easily; but not without also considering the rigor required to perform the phenomenological reduction.

One important feature of the way Fink sets up his discussion of the ground and his illustration of the rigor required in the performance of the phenomenological reduction is his dramatic use of Plato’s allegory of the cave. He says, “the violence, tension and struggle of the accomplishment of philosophizing symbolized in this allegory also determines the phenomenological philosophy of Edmund Husserl” (Accomplish, p. 160/9). If there is any doubt as to how we should understand the terms “violence” and “struggle,” as he uses them in this context, Fink dispatches it immediately with the following: “The philosophical ‘unchaining,’ the tearing oneself free from the power of one’s naïve submission to the world, the stepping-forth from out of that familiarity with entities which always provides us with security, in one word, the phenomenological ‘epoché,’ is anything but a noncommittal, ‘merely’ theoretical, intellectual act; it is rather a spiritual movement of one’s self encompassing the entire man and, as an attack upon the ‘state-of-motionlessness’ supporting us in our depths, the pain of a fundamental transformation down to our roots” (p. 160-1/9). It should be clear that Fink’s use of terms such as “violence,” “struggle,” “unchaining,” “pain,” and “fundamental transformation” indicate a much more rigorous project than armchair philosophy has been wont to allow up to this point. But what is it that makes it so rigorous; what is it that we do when we perform the phenomenological reduction?

We get a preliminary description of what is required from Fink: “Our era can really attain to Husserl’s philosophy, which down to today is still unknown and ungrasped, only by ascending out of the cave of world-constraint, by passing through the pain of self-releasement—and not through ‘critiques’ that are thoroughly bound to the naïve understanding of the world, enslaved to the natural thought-habits and entangled in the pre-constituted word-meanings of the everyday and scientific language” (p. 161/10). Here, again, we find familiar language; language that might have been encountered in any number of Husserl’s other writings, but what is of interest to us in this passage is the picture of what it is we are “ascending out of.” In this regard, it is helpful to recall the phrase used in Sixth Cartesian Meditation to describe the same thing, namely, “captivation-in-an-acceptedness.” The situation Fink is describing is this: the lives that we live in our everyday world are lived in toto with that world, i.e., the world, as we understand it, is part of what makes us who we think we are; and, conversely, the world is only what it is (what we think it is) by virtue of having us in it, because when we think of the totality of the world, we must remember that it is a totality already containing us thinking it. Hence, we (the world and ourselves) hold each other mutually captive by virtue of what we accept—the acceptednesses—to be true. This reflexive containment is part of what Fink means when he says, “To know the world by returning to a ‘transcendence’ which once again contains the world within it signifies the realization of a transcendental knowledge of the world. This is the sole sense in which phenomenology is to be considered as a ‘transcendental philosophy’” (Criticism, p. 100).

With this statement we finally arrive at the core of what Fink means to communicate; the phenomenological reduction is self-meditation radicalized. On its face, his statement may seem to involve the presupposition that the self is already estranged from its own essence; however, as Fink points out, “phenomenology does not begin with a ‘presupposition’; rather, by an extreme enhancement and transformation of the natural self-meditation, it leads to the ground-experience which opens-up not only the concealed-authentic essence of the spirit, but also the authentic sense of the natural sphere from out of which self-meditation comes forth” (Accomplish, p. 166/14-15). The ground-experience, furthermore, can succeed “only when, with the most extreme sharpness and consequence, every naïve claiming of the mundane-ontological self-understanding is cut off, when the spirit is forced back upon itself to Interpret itself purely as that ‘self’ which is the bearer and accomplisher of the valuation of every natural ‘self-understanding’” (p. 169/17-18). This view is already made explicit in direct connection with the phenomenological onlooker in Fink’s discussion in Sixth Cartesian Meditation (pp. 39-40). The meditation does not bring the reducing “I” into being; the reducing “I” is disclosed once the shrouding cover of human being is removed. That is, by un-humanizing ourselves we discover the reducing “I”—the phenomenological onlooker who is the one practicing the epoché.

Now we can more clearly grasp the meaning of Fink’s statement; when he speaks of spirit being “forced back upon itself,” the “itself” is the phenomenological onlooker—spirit; and the radicalization of self-meditation is the procedure whereby we discover what Husserl earlier referred to as “I am, this life is.” This is “radicalization” precisely because it is to be done without any reference to the mundane. Let me explain, the world is familiarly and horizonally pre-given to us in its totality; furthermore, we are pre-given in it. So, the mundane-ontological self-interpretedness of the spirit is a moment in the totality of the pre-givenness of the world. Hence, if we use any element of the mundane-ontological interpretedness of the world, we have not exercised a “radical” shift. In order for the shift to be truly radical in Husserl’s sense, no element of the mundane can enter into either the motivation for self-meditation or into the ground of it—in the sense of an understanding of the essence of spirit prior to the ground-experience that brings spirit to itself. What we want to accomplish is a radical shift in which the spirit (phenomenological onlooker) is forced back upon itself to interpret itself purely as that “self” that is the bearer (as the human ego) and accomplisher (transcendental constituting ego) of the valuation of the entirety of the mundane-ontological self-interpretedness.

The radical nature of the phenomenological reduction seems to have been greatly underdetermined by some and that we can only get a truly accurate picture of what Husserl means by taking seriously his claim that, not only is the reduction radical, but it is radical in a “new” sense of that term; this “new” radicality is linked directly to self-meditation that has been radicalized—radicalized, that is, insofar as it is a self-meditation that is “forced back upon itself to Interpret itself purely as that ‘self’ which is the bearer and accomplisher of the valuation of every natural ‘self-understanding.’” One practical way to grasp what it means for the self to be “forced back upon itself to interpret itself purely as that ‘self’ which is the bearer and accomplisher of the valuation of every natural ‘self-understanding,’” is to understand this ‘self’ as the “I” in “I am.” Let us now take a closer look at exactly how this technique is performed.

c. The Performance of the Phenomenological Reduction

Husserl criticizes scientific inquiry on the grounds that it does not have a philosophically rigorous foundation. The reason it does not have a philosophically rigorous foundation is because it has failed to take into consideration the fact that both the framework of its own inquiry (that is, the assumptions of time, space, causality, etc.) and the psychological assumptions of the individual scientist act to color its findings. Since there has to be a way that consciousness can contact the objective world, then the rigorous philosophical grounding that is wanted must be disclosed in this relationship. Hence, what is needed is a way to examine consciousness as it is in itself, free from the scientific framework and psychological assumptions. This procedure is the phenomenological reduction and the term “reduction” is a term that Husserl uses to indicate a reflective inquiring back into consciousness; it is an interrogation conducted by consciousness into itself. In the idiom of our own everyday parlance, we might phrase this inquiry as an exercise in determining who the “I” is whenever we say “I AM.” Indeed, the path that we naturally follow in seeking an answer to this question leads precisely to the kind of interrogation of the self by the self that Husserl and Fink both claim to be ingredient in the performance of the reduction.

i. Self-Meditation

Phrases such as “resolved to understand the world out of the spirit,” “spiritual movement,” “religious conversion,” “fundamental transformation,” “ground experience,” “un-humanize,” and “meditation” are all leading clues as to how this technique should be understood and performed. We know that the technique is similar to the ordinary self-meditation, only radicalized; we know that it requires strenuous effort and, once completed, brings a transformation similar to a religious conversion. We also know that in the process we are “un-humanized” yet have the “entire man” encompassed. These leading clues not only direct our steps in the performance of the technique, but also give us criteria by which to judge our attempts. For instance, if we think we have performed the reduction, then we should feel as though we have experienced a religious transformation; if we do not feel that way, then chances are our technique was faulty and we did not perform it after all.

If we are to build up a picture of this technique we must begin by assuming that Husserl and Fink have an authentic discovery that they are trying to communicate and that their choice of terms to describe this experience is not careless. The title of Fink’s article gives us the framework we need to complete this task. He tells us right away that he is interested in the idea of laying a ground. Laying a ground is another way of saying that preparation is being made; indeed, the ground that is laid is preparing the way for the phenomenological philosophy of Edmund Husserl; and the ground in question is the philosopher. Fink is telling us that the philosopher is the ground for phenomenology and that the philosopher, as ground, needs preparation. What is it that prepares the philosopher to be the ground for phenomenology? It is the phenomenological reduction. The phenomenological reduction prepares the philosopher to be a phenomenologist in the same way that the experience associated with religious conversion prepares the devotee to live the religious life. Husserl says in the Crisis: “the total phenomenological attitude and the epoché belonging to it are destined in essence to effect…a complete personal transformation, comparable in the beginning to a religious conversion, which then, however, over and above this, bears within itself the significance of the greatest existential transformation which is assigned as a task to mankind as such” (p.137).

The phenomenological reduction is properly understood as a regimen designed to transform a philosopher into a phenomenologist by virtue of the attainment of a certain perspective on the world phenomenon. The path to the attainment of this perspective is a species of meditation, requiring rigorous and persistent effort. It is a species of meditation because, unlike ordinary meditation, which involves only the mind, this more radical form requires the participation of the entire individual, including, as Fink says, “the pathos of the one who is philosophizing.” However, because it is a species of meditation, one can assume the basic starting point of stilling the body, mind, and emotions while sitting in a comfortable position, having made provisions not to be disturbed. What is aimed at with these outward preparations is the goal of taking as much of the world “out of play” as possible, leaving only the meditative task to occupy one’s attention.

Once settled in this comfort, the “inquiring back” into consciousness may begin; it is the having of the self as the only object of meditation that makes this a self-meditation. Since what we are after is a self-meditation, the focus of attention is on the self and the radicalization of this meditation consists in one relentlessly pushing back and forcing the self onto itself. This can be done by repeatedly affirming, not merely saying, “I am” to oneself while trying to experience or “catch” the “I” in the present instead of remembering it. In the attempt to experience the “I” in the present, one will be forced to feel the I-ness of it; this is why Fink says the performance of the technique encompasses the “entire man” and speaks of the “pathos of the one who is philosophizing.”

In the course of this practice, one will become aware of the three “I”s: the human ego, the constituting ego, and the onlooker, or spectator. It is unlikely that much progress will be made on the first attempt; however, each try makes the return easier until there will come a day when you feel your consciousness rising (or yourself sinking) and the brightness of the world around you seems to be increasing. At that point you will know “I AM” and your perspective on the world will be the one that Husserl has promised—you will be a phenomenologist and will never be the same again. Indeed, Fink says that “the phenomenological ‘epoché,’ is anything but a noncommittal, ‘merely’ theoretical, intellectual act; it is rather a spiritual [geistig] movement of one’s self encompassing the entire man and, as an attack upon the ‘state-of-motionlessness’ supporting us in our depths, the pain of a fundamental transformation down to our roots” (Accomplish, p. 9). Adding that in the epoché “the transcendental tendency that awakens in man and drives him to inhibit all acceptednesses nullifies man himself; man un-humanizes [entmenscht] himself” (Sixth, 40). It should be clear from these passages that whatever is involved in the epoché, it is certainly no mere mental exercise; and if we take Fink and Husserl at their word, it is a “spiritual movement of one’s self encompassing the entire man,” which would indicate a far more radical effort than seems indicated by some who treat the phenomenological reduction as something no more strenuous than exercising the imagination or reciting an incantation.

6. How the Reduction Solves the Epistemological Problem

a. The Problem of Constitution

I have already noted that in his Philosophy of Arithmetic Husserl found serious fault with psychologism in his efforts to emancipate ideal objects from psychology and demonstrate their independence. With this critique, however, came the following question: How do the ideal objects come to be given? This is simply the question concerning the correlation of subject and object noted above with respect to the tree and the quad. In his “The Decisive Phases in the Development of Husserl’s Philosophy,” Walter Biemel addresses this very concern and brings his considerable familiarity with Husserl’s works to bear upon it. He offers the following quotation from the Nachlass (F I 36, B1.19a f.) for consideration: “When it is made evident that ideal objects, despite the fact that they are formed in consciousness, have their own being in themselves, there still remains an enormous task which has never been seriously viewed or taken up, namely, the task of making this unique correlation between the ideal objects which belong to the sphere of pure logic and the subjective psychical experience conceived as a formative activity a theme for investigation. When a psychical subject such as I, this thinking being, performs certain (and surely not arbitrary but quite specifically structured) psychical activities in my own psychical life, then a successive formation and production of meaning is enacted according to which the number-form in question, the truth in question, or the conclusion and proof in question…emerges as the successively developing product.”

Biemel uses this quotation to make the point that in it Husserl expresses his real concern and the real theme of his phenomenology; Biemel draws our attention to the parenthetical phrase concerning psychical activities, namely, “(and surely not arbitrary but quite specifically structured),” to make the point that “the subject cannot arbitrarily constitute (and surely the issue here is that of constitution) any meaning whatsoever; rather are the constitutive acts dependent upon the essence of the objects in question.” In other words, if we are to consider the essence of the number three, for example, it is not the case that the essence of that number, contra psychologism, is dependent upon what psychical activities are required in order to form the number; rather, in order to understand the meaning of the number three, “we must perform determinate acts of collective connecting, otherwise the meaning of 3 in general will remain entirely closed to us. There is something like the number three for us when we can perform the collecting-unifying activity in which three become capable of being presented.” This does not mean that the essence of the number three would be arbitrarily determined by this activity so that the number would in each case change according to the manner in which one constitutes it. “Either I perform the acts which disclose the essence of the number three, with the result that for me there is something like three, or I do not perform them and then there is no 3 except for those who have performed this activity.” This “collecting-unifying activity” is the activity of constitution.

Biemel reminds us that the problem of constitution is the source of many a misunderstanding and adds, “the ordinary use of ‘constitution’ equates it with any kind of production, but ‘constitution’ in the strong sense is more of a ‘restitution’ than a constitution insofar as the subject ‘restores’ what is already there, but this, however, requires the performance of certain activities.” Citing a letter from Husserl to Hocking dated January 25, 1903, Biemel drives his point home: “Regarding the meaning of the concept of constitution employed in the Logical Investigations Husserl states: ‘The recurring expression that ‘objects are constituted’ in an act always signifies the property of an act which makes the object present (vorstellig): not ‘constitution’ in the usual sense.’” Hence, the best way to discuss the concept of constitution, says Biemel, is to discuss it as the-becoming-present-of-an-object; and the acts which make this becoming-present possible, which set it in motion, are the constituting acts. Or, as Husserl would put it in his Formal and Transcendental Logic, “This manner of givenness—givenness as something coming from such original activity—is nothing other than the way of their being ‘perceived’ which uniquely belongs to them.”

This problem of constitution first appears in the Logical Investigations and continues to be one of the basic problems of phenomenology; however, the interest in it here is that constitution figures prominently in the resolution of the epistemological problem.

b. The Reduction and the Theme of Philosophy

In his “The Problem of the Phenomenology of Edmund Husserl,” Fink allows that access to the fundamental problem of Husserl’s phenomenology is uncertain owing to the fact that the fundamental problem of any philosophy is often not identical with the particular questions with which its literature begins. Indeed, the fundamental problem may often even await a proper formulation; one that can emerge only after the philosopher’s later stages of the development of his or her own thought are reworked. And although Husserl’s thought started with the sense-formation of mathematics and logic, these interests do not comprise what Fink terms the genuine problem or theme of phenomenology.

This very zigzag process of moving back and forth from one stage to the whole and back again within which the formulation of the genuine problem occurs discloses a distinction between two types of knowing. The first type is one in which we are engaged in a developmental process that will answer certain formulatable questions; that is, it is an expecting-to-know that is characterized chiefly by the fact that it advances an already established body of knowledge—in short, it is a knowing about knowledge that is lacking. For instance, in archaeology we might plan digs in areas surrounding certain cities expecting to add to our stock of knowledge about the ancient life in that setting in order to fill in known gaps in our accounts. This is knowledge of what is lacking.

This type of knowing is not, however, the type of knowing that emerges in the zigzag process to which I just referred. The type of knowing prevalent in the zigzag process is one in which what is obvious becomes questionable; not in the sense of creating arbitrary doubts or from the mere mistrust of the human mind; rather, questionable because, as Fink says, “philosophy is an experience that man has of himself and the existent;” and it is owing to this that the origin of philosophical problems is wonder. This means that “problem” in the philosophical sense is not an expecting-to-know on the basis of a path to knowledge but rather the formation of an expecting-to-know. Philosophy is, therefore, the shaking of the ground which bears human familiarity with the existent; it is the shaking of the basis which forms the presupposition for the progressive augmentation of knowledge, i.e., the shaking of the basis of expecting-to-know of the first type. It is the very unsettling of the foundations of knowledge and the questioning of the existent qua existent as well as the questioning of the nature of truth.

The astonishment in question is just the very experience that man has of himself and the existent that is the foundation needed for epistemology; because it is in this wonder that the “unsettling idea of a genuine mode of knowing the existent suddenly emerges from beneath the ordered, familiar world in which we are at home and about which we have fixed meanings concerning things, man and God, meanings which make certainty in life possible.” It is a “genuine mode” precisely because it is not already decided what the nature of the existent and the nature of truth are; after all, it cannot be original if the original formation of the ideas of “existent” and “truth” has already occurred; whether it is decided through a lengthy effort belonging to the past of human spirit or through the inconspicuous obviousness of the natural world-view. In other words, the only “knowing” that is original is the “knowing” that properly belongs to astonishment; because it is only in astonishment that man experiences the complete collapse of his traditional knowledge and pre-acquaintance with the world and with things; a collapse that is due entirely to a new confronting of the existent and a new projection of the senses of “being” and “truth.” We should be sensitive to Fink’s use of the term “original” here because the way he uses it in this passage heralds the sense of “founding” invoked in the way phenomenology provides a ground for epistemology.

Fink has told us that the astonishment in which philosophy begins is in no way “merely a ‘disposition,’ a feeling.” Rather, “it is the fundamental disposition of pure thought; it is original theory.” What Fink means to communicate with this is that in astonishment a change and transformation of knowing occurs such that what we already know is reduced to mere opinion and that even the very nature of knowing is altered. In other words, Fink marks a distinction between the “knowing” that stands in need of a foundation and the “knowing” that does the founding. The knowing that does the founding is the original knowing of astonishment; it is original precisely because it does not come to the existent and truth with conceptions in hand, having already decided their nature; and the door to sustained astonishment is opened by the rigorous performance of the phenomenological reduction.

It should not be inferred from this passage that there is anything whimsical about the way astonishment proclaims the existent; as though, for example, that being and truth are presented as mere conventions. Rather, what is wanted is the ability to, as Fink says, sustain and develop astonishment “by the awakening force of conceptual cognition” because it is the extent of the creative force of wonder that ultimately determines the rank and achievement of a philosophy. It is precisely this burden that is borne by the phenomenological reduction, which aims at voluntarily awakening the force of conceptual cognition and sustaining it throughout intentional analysis. Thus, it is borne out as was noted above that philosophy does not begin with an assumption but an experience; namely, the experience of having performed the phenomenological reduction. This experience is the astonishment in which original knowing occurs; and it is upon original knowing that the “knowing” of the existent, or epistemology, is grounded.

This relation, in which a physical experience is the condition for the possibility of thought, is not new to philosophy; logical analysis crucially depends upon one having the ability (experience) to be aware of logical connections; absent this ability, as Wittgenstein has also noticed, there is nothing we can do to atone for it in the individual—the individual either sees the logical connections or does not. It is the experience of being aware of, and noticing, logical connections that really grounds logical analysis. So, too, with the phenomenological reduction; without the experience of astonishment granted by having successfully performed the phenomenological reduction, no epistemology can be truly grounded because every epistemological claim must sometime trace itself back to the original knowledge; and the original knowledge can be had only in astonishment, the very fruit of accurately performing the phenomenological reduction. In other words, the ground for epistemology is, in the final analysis, the philosopher’s own astonishment; if this astonishment is voluntarily taken up and sustained, as in the performance of the phenomenological reduction, then the report of what is disclosed in that experience can be entered into the stock of human knowledge as an epistemological datum. And, in the same way that the validity of any logical argument is verified by each individual at every step by seeing for him or herself whether each step follows logically from the previous step by invoking one’s own ability to recognize logical connections, every epistemological datum must be similarly verified by the phenomenologist returning to astonishment through the phenomenological reduction and comparing the results achieved with those at hand. What is needed to assure consistent results and the scientific rigor Husserl said properly belonged to phenomenology is a more careful adherence to the rigorous conditions of performing the phenomenological reduction by phenomenologists so that it does not deteriorate into the psychologistic practice of free association or mere mental exercise; it is, after all, a rigorous meditative exercise requiring the struggle of the whole person.

7. References and Further Reading

Berger, Gaston. The Cogito in Husserl’s Philosophy. Translated by Kathleen McLaughlin. Evanston: Northwestern University Press, 1972.
Bernet, Rudolf. “Phenomenological Reduction and the Double Life of the Subject.” In Reading Heidegger from the Start: Essays in His Earliest Thought, eds. Theodore Kisiel and John van Buren, Albany: SUNY Press, 1994.
Bernet, Rudolf, Iso Kern, and Eduard Marbach. An Introduction to Husserlian Phenomenology. Evanston: Northwestern University Press, 1993.
Biemel, Walter. “Les Phases decisive dans le development de la philosophie de Husserl.” In Husserl: Cahiers de Royaumont, no III. Paris: Minuit, 1959.
Bochiniski, I.M. Contemporary European Philosophy. Translated by Donald Nicholl and Karl Aschenbrenner. Berkeley: University of California Press, 1966.
Boehm, Rudolf. “Basic Reflections on Husserl’s Phenomenological Reduction.” International Philosophical Quarterly 5 (1965): 183-202.
Boehm, Rudolf. “Les Ambiguités des Concepts Husserliens d’‘immanence’ et de ‘transcendence.’” Revue Philosophique de la France et de l’Etranger 149 (1959): 481-526.
Boehm, Rudolf. Vom Gesichtspunkt der Phänomenologie. Den Haag: Martinus Nijhoff, 1968.
Boehm, Rudolf. Vom Gesichtspunkt der Phänomenologie II. Den Haag: Martinus Nijhoff, 1981.
Bruzina, Ronald. “Construction in Phenomenology.” In The Reach of Reflection: Issues for Phenomenology’s Second Century, eds. Steven Crowell, Lester Embree, and Samuel J. Julian (Electron Press, October 2001), 46-71.
Bruzina, Ronald. Edmund Husserl and Eugen Fink: Beginnings and Ends in Phenomenology 1928-1938. New Haven: Yale University Press, 2004.
Carr, David. “The ‘Fifth Meditation’ and Husserl’s Cartesianism.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research. 34:14-35, 1973.
Carr, David. The Paradox of Subjectivity: The Self in the Transcendental Tradition. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1999.
Depraz, Natalie, and Marc Richir, eds. Eugen Fink: Actes Du Colloque de Cerisy-la-Salle 23-30 Juillet 1994. Atlanta: Rodopi, 1997.
Elveton, R. O., ed. The Phenomenology of Husserl: Selected Readings. Chicago:Quadrangle Books, 1970.
Farber, Marvin. The Aims of Phenomenology: The Motives, Methods, and Impact of Husserl’s Thought. New York: Harper Torchbooks, 1966.
Farber, Marvin. The Foundation of Phenomenology: Edmund Husserl and the Quest for a Rigorous Science of Philosophy. Albany: SUNY Press, 1943.
Fink, Eugen. “L’Analyse intentionnelle et le probleme de la pensee speculative.” In Problemes actuels de la phenomenologie, 54-87. Brussels: Desclee de Brower, 1952.
Fink, Eugen. “The Phenomenological Philosophy of Edmund Husserl and Contemporary Criticism.” In The Phenomenology of Husserl, 73-147. Chicago: Quadrangle Books, 1970.
Fink, Eugen. Sixth Cartesian Meditation: The Idea of a Transcendental Theory of Method. Translated by Ronald Bruzina. Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1995.
Fink, Eugen. “Was Will Die Phänomenologie Edmund Husserls,” in Studien zur Phänomenologie 1930-1939 (Den Haag: Martinus Nijhoff, 1966).
Fink, Eugen. “What Does the Phenomenology of Edmund Husserl Want to Accomplish?” Translated by Arthur Grugan. Research in Phenomenology 2, (1972): 5-27.
Hopkins, Burt C. “Husserl’s Account of Phenomenological Reflection and Four Paradoxes of Reflexivity.” Research in Phenomenology 19, (1989): 180-194.
Husserl, Edmund. Analyses Concerning Passive and Active Synthesis: Lectures on Transcendental Logic. Translated by Anthony J. Steinbock. Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers, 2001.
Husserl, Edmund. Cartesian Meditations. Translated by Dorion Cairns. The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1977.
Husserl, Edmund. The Crisis of European Sciences and Transcendental Phenomenology. Translated by David Carr. Evanston: Northwestern University Press, 1970.
Husserl, Edmund. Husserliana Vol. VIII. Erste Philosophie (1923/24), II. Edited by Rudolf Boehm. Haag: Martinus Nijhoff, 1959.
Husserl, Edmund. Experience and Judgment. Translated by James S. Churchill and Karl Ameriks. Evanston: Northwestern University Press, 1973.
Husserl, Edmund. Formal and Transcendental Logic. Translated by Dorion Cairns. The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1969.
Husserl, Edmund. The Idea of Phenomenology. Translated by William P. Alston and George Nakhnikian. The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1973.
Husserl, Edmund. The Idea of Phenomenology. Translated by Lee Hardy. Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers, 1999.
Husserl, Edmund. Ideas Pertaining to a Pure Phenomenology and to a Phenomenological Philosophy: First Book. Translated by F. Kersten. Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers, 1998.
Husserl, Edmund. Ideas Pertaining to a Pure Phenomenology and to a Phenomenological Philosophy: Second Book. Translated by R. Rojcewicz and A. Schuwer. Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers, 1989.
Husserl, Edmund. Ideas: General Introduction to Pure Phenomenology. Translated by W. F. Boyce Gibson. New York: Collier Books, 1962.
Husserl, Edmund. Logical Investigations. Translated by J. N. Findlay. 2Vols. London: Routledge and Kegan Paul, 1970.
Husserl, Edmund. Phenomenology and the Crisis of Philosophy. Translated by Quentin Lauer. New York: Harper Torchbooks, 1965.
Husserl, Edmund. The Phenomenology of Internal Time-consciousness. Translated by James S. Churchill. Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1964.
Kearney, Richard and Mara Rainwater, eds. The Continental Philosophy Reader. London: Routledge, 1998.
Kersten, Fred. “Notes From Underground: Merleau-Ponty and Husserl’s Sixth Cartesian Meditation.” In The Prism of the Self, ed. Steven Crowell. Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers, no date.
Kockelmans, Joseph J, ed. Phenomenology: The Philosophy of Edmund Husserl and Its Interpretation. Garden City, New York: Doubleday, 1967.
Lauer, Quentin. Phenomenology: Its Genesis and Prospect. New York: Harper Torchbooks, 1965.
Lawlor, Leonard. Derrida and Husserl: The Basic Problem of Phenomenology. Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 2002.
McKenna, William, Robert M. Harlan and Laurence E. Winters, eds. Apriori and World: European Contributions to Husserlian Phenomenology. The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1981.
Natanson, Maurice. Edmund Husserl: Philosopher of Infinite Tasks. Evanston: Northwestern University Press, 1973.
Ricoeur, Paul. “Husserl’s Fifth Cartesian Meditation.” In Husserl: An Analysis of His Phenomenology. Translated by Edward G. Ballard and Lester Embree. Evanston: Northwestern University Press, 1967.
Ricoeur, Paul. “A Study of Husserl’s Cartesian Meditations I-IV.” In Husserl An Analysis of His Phenomenology. Translated by Edward G. Ballard and Lester Embree. Evanston: Northwestern University Press, 1967.
Sokolowski, Robert. Husserlian Meditations. Evanston: Northwestern University Press, 1974.
Souche-Daques, S. “La Lecture Husserlienne de Sein und Zeit.” Philosophie 21 (1989): 7-36.
Stapleton, Timothy J. “The ‘Logic’ of Husserl’s Transcendental Reduction.” Man and World 15 (1982): 369-382.
Welton, Donn, ed. The Essential Husserl: Basic Writings in Transcendental Phenomenology. Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1999.
Welton, Donn, ed. The New Husserl: A Critical Reader. Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 2003.
Zahavi, Dan. Husserl and Transcendental Intersubjectivity. Translated by Elizabeth A. Behnke. Athens, Ohio: Ohio University Press, 2001.
Zahavi, Dan. Husserl’s Phenomenology. Stanford: Stanford University Press, 2003.

Author Information

John Cogan
Email: jmcogan@siu.edu
St. Petersburg College
U. S. A.

René Descartes:
The Mind-Body Distinction

One of the deepest and most lasting legacies of Descartes’ philosophy is his thesis that mind and body are really distinct—a thesis now called “mind-body dualism.” He reaches this conclusion by arguing that the nature of the mind (that is, a thinking, non-extended thing) is completely different from that of the body (that is, an extended, non-thinking thing), and therefore it is possible for one to exist without the other. This argument gives rise to the famous problem of mind-body causal interaction still debated today: how can the mind cause some of our bodily limbs to move (for example, raising one’s hand to ask a question), and how can the body’s sense organs cause sensations in the mind when their natures are completely different? This article examines these issues as well as Descartes’ own response to this problem through his brief remarks on how the mind is united with the body to form a human being. This will show how these issues arise because of a misconception about Descartes’ theory of mind-body union, and how the correct conception of their union avoids this version of the problem. The article begins with an examination of the term “real distinction” and of Descartes’ probable motivations for maintaining his dualist thesis.

What is a Real Distinction?
Why a Real Distinction?
1. The Religious Motivation
2. The Scientific Motivation
The Real Distinction Argument
1. The First Version
2. The Second Version
The Mind-Body Problem
Descartes’ Response to the Mind-Body Problem
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources
2. Secondary Sources

1. What is a Real Distinction?

It is important to note that for Descartes “real distinction” is a technical term denoting the distinction between two or more substances (see Principles, part I, section 60). A substance is something that does not require any other creature to exist—it can exist with only the help of God’s concurrence—whereas, a mode is a quality or affection of that substance (see Principles part I, section 5). Accordingly, a mode requires a substance to exist and not just the concurrence of God. Being sphere shaped is a mode of an extended substance. For example, a sphere requires an object extended in three dimensions in order to exist: an unextended sphere cannot be conceived without contradiction. But a substance can be understood to exist alone without requiring any other creature to exist. For example, a stone can exist all by itself. That is, its existence is not dependent upon the existence of minds or other bodies; and, a stone can exist without being any particular size or shape. This indicates for Descartes that God, if he chose, could create a world constituted by this stone all by itself, showing further that it is a substance “really distinct” from everything else except God. Hence, the thesis that mind and body are really distinct just means that each could exist all by itself without any other creature, including each other, if God chose to do it. However, this does not mean that these substances do exist separately. Whether or not they actually exist apart is another issue entirely.

2. Why a Real Distinction?

A question one might ask is: what’s the point of arguing that mind and body could each exist without the other? What’s the payoff for going through all the trouble and enduring all the problems to which it gives rise? For Descartes the payoff is twofold. The first is religious in nature in that it provides a rational basis for a hope in the soul’s immortality [because Descartes presumes that the mind and soul are more or less the same thing]. The second is more scientifically oriented, for the complete absence of mentality from the nature of physical things is central to making way for Descartes’ version of the new, mechanistic physics. This section investigates both of these motivating factors.

a. The Religious Motivation

In his Letter to the Sorbonne published at the beginning of his seminal work, Meditations on First Philosophy, Descartes states that his purpose in showing that the human mind or soul is really distinct from the body is to refute those “irreligious people” who only have faith in mathematics and will not believe in the soul’s immortality without a mathematical demonstration of it. Descartes goes on to explain how, because of this, these people will not pursue moral virtue without the prospect of an afterlife with rewards for virtue and punishments for vice. But, since all the arguments in the Meditations—including the real distinction arguments— are for Descartes absolutely certain on a par with geometrical demonstrations, he believes that these people will be obliged to accept them. Hence, irreligious people will be forced to believe in the prospect of an afterlife. However, recall that Descartes’ conclusion is only that the mind or soul can exist without the body. He stops short of demonstrating that the soul is actually immortal. Indeed, in the Synopsis to the Mediations, Descartes claims only to have shown that the decay of the body does not logically or metaphysically imply the destruction of the mind: further argumentation is required for the conclusion that the mind actually survives the body’s destruction. This would involve both “an account of the whole of physics” and an argument showing that God cannot annihilate the mind. Yet, even though the real distinction argument does not go this far, it does, according to Descartes, provide a sufficient foundation for religion, since the hope for an afterlife now has a rational basis and is no longer a mere article of faith.

b. The Scientific Motivation

The other motive for arguing that mind and body could each exist without the other is more scientifically oriented, stemming from Descartes’ intended replacement of final causal explanations in physics thought to be favored by late scholastic-Aristotelian philosophers with mechanistic explanations based on the model of geometry. Although the credit for setting the stage for this scholastic-Aristotelian philosophy dominant at Descartes’ time should go to Thomas Aquinas (because of his initial, thorough interpretation and appropriation of Aristotle’s philosophy), it is also important to bear in mind that other thinkers working within this Aristotelian framework such as Duns Scotus, William of Ockham, and Francisco Suarez, diverged from the Thomistic position on a variety of important issues. Indeed, by Descartes’ time, scholastic positions divergent from Thomism became so widespread and subtle in their differences that sorting them out was quite difficult. Notwithstanding this convoluted array of positions, Descartes understood one thesis to stand at the heart of the entire tradition: the doctrine that everything ultimately behaved for the sake of some end or goal. Though these “final causes,” as they were called, were not the only sorts of causes recognized by scholastic thinkers, it is sufficient for present purposes to recognize that Descartes believed scholastic natural philosophers used them as principles for physical explanations. For this reason, a brief look at how final causes were supposed to work is in order.

Descartes understood all scholastics to maintain that everything was thought to have a final cause that is the ultimate end or goal for the sake of which the rest of the organism was organized. This principle of organization became known as a thing’s “substantial form,” because it was this principle that explained why some hunk of matter was arranged in such and such a way so as to be some species of substance. For example, in the case of a bird, say, the swallow, the substantial form of swallowness was thought to organize matter for the sake of being a swallow species of substance. Accordingly, any dispositions a swallow might have, such as the disposition for making nests, would then also be explained by means of this ultimate goal of being a swallow; that is, swallows are disposed for making nests for the sake of being a swallow species of substance. This explanatory scheme was also thought to work for plants and inanimate natural objects.

A criticism of the traditional employment of substantial forms and their concomitant final causes in physics is found in the Sixth Replies where Descartes examines how the quality of gravity was used to explain a body’s downward motion:

But what makes it especially clear that my idea of gravity was taken largely from the idea I had of the mind is the fact that I thought that gravity carried bodies toward the centre of the earth as if it had some knowledge of the centre within itself (AT VII 442: CSM II 298).

On this pre-Newtonian account, a characteristic goal of all bodies was to reach its proper place, namely, the center of the earth. So, the answer to the question, “Why do stones fall downward?” would be, “Because they are striving to achieve their goal of reaching the center of the earth.” According to Descartes, this implies that the stone must have knowledge of this goal, know the means to attain it, and know where the center of the earth is located. But, how can a stone know anything? Surely only minds can have knowledge. Yet, since stones are inanimate bodies without minds, it follows that they cannot know anything at all—let alone anything about the center of the earth.

Descartes continues on to make the following point:

But later on I made the observations which led me to make a careful distinction between the idea of the mind and the ideas of body and corporeal motion; and I found that all those other ideas of . . . ‘substantial forms’ which I had previously held were ones which I had put together or constructed from those basic ideas (AT VII 442-3: CSM II 298).

Here, Descartes is claiming that the concept of a substantial form as part of the entirely physical world stems from a confusion of the ideas of mind and body. This confusion led people to mistakenly ascribe mental properties like knowledge to entirely non-mental things like stones, plants, and, yes, even non-human animals. The real distinction of mind and body can then also be used to alleviate this confusion and its resultant mistakes by showing that bodies exist and move as they do without mentality, and as such principles of mental causation such as goals, purposes (that is, final causes), and knowledge have no role to play in the explanation of physical phenomena. So the real distinction of mind and body also serves the more scientifically oriented end of eliminating any element of mentality from the idea of body. In this way, a clear understanding of the geometrical nature of bodies can be achieved and better explanations obtained.

3. The Real Distinction Argument

Descartes formulates this argument in many different ways, which has led many scholars to believe there are several different real distinction arguments. However, it is more accurate to consider these formulations as different versions of one and the same argument. The fundamental premise of each is identical: each has the fundamental premise that the natures of mind and body are completely different from one another.

The First Version

The first version is found in this excerpt from the Sixth Meditation:

[O]n the one hand I have a clear and distinct idea of myself, in so far as I am simply a thinking, non-extended thing [that is, a mind], and on the other hand I have a distinct idea of body, in so far as this is simply an extended, non-thinking thing. And accordingly, it is certain that I am really distinct from my body, and can exist without it (AT VII 78: CSM II 54).

Notice that the argument is given from the first person perspective (as are the entire Meditations). This “I” is, of course, Descartes insofar as he is a thinking thing or mind, and the argument is intended to work for any “I” or mind. So, for present purposes, it is safe to generalize the argument by replacing “I” with “mind” in the relevant places:

I have a clear and distinct idea of the mind as a thinking, non-extended thing.
I have a clear and distinct idea of body as an extended, non-thinking thing.
Therefore, the mind is really distinct from the body and can exist without it.

At first glance it may seem that, without justification, Descartes is bluntly asserting that he conceives of mind and body as two completely different things, and that from his conception, he is inferring that he (or any mind) can exist without the body. But this is no blunt, unjustified assertion. Much more is at work here: most notably what is at work is his doctrine of clear and distinct ideas and their veridical guarantee. Indeed the truth of his intellectual perception of the natures of mind and body is supposed to be guaranteed by the fact that this perception is “clear and distinct.” Since the justification for these two premises rests squarely on the veridical guarantee of whatever is “clearly and distinctly” perceived, a brief side trip explaining this doctrine is in order.

Descartes explains what he means by a “clear and distinct idea” in his work Principles of Philosophy at part I, section 45. Here he likens a clear intellectual perception to a clear visual perception. So, just as someone might have a sharply focused visual perception of something, an idea is clear when it is in sharp intellectual focus. Moreover, an idea is distinct when, in addition to being clear, all other ideas not belonging to it are completely excluded from it. Hence, Descartes is claiming in both premises that his idea of the mind and his idea of the body exclude all other ideas that do not belong to them, including each other, and all that remains is what can be clearly understood of each. As a result, he clearly and distinctly understands the mind all by itself, separately from the body, and the body all by itself, separately from the mind.

According to Descartes, his ability to clearly and distinctly understand them separately from one another implies that each can exist alone without the other. This is because “[e]xistence is contained in the idea or concept of every single thing, since we cannot conceive of anything except as existing. Possible or contingent existence is contained in the concept of a limited thing…” (AT VII 166: CSM II 117). Descartes, then, clearly and distinctly perceives the mind as possibly existing all by itself, and the body as possibly existing all by itself. But couldn’t Descartes somehow be mistaken about his clear and distinct ideas? Given the existence of so many non-thinking bodies like stones, there is no question that bodies can exist without minds. So, even if he could be mistaken about what he clearly and distinctly understands, there is other evidence in support of premise 2. But can minds exist without bodies? Can thinking occur without a brain? If the answer to this question is “no,” the first premise would be false and, therefore, Descartes would be mistaken about one of his clear and distinct perceptions. Indeed, since we have no experience of minds actually existing without bodies as we do of bodies actually existing without minds, the argument will stand only if Descartes’ clear and distinct understanding of the mind’s nature somehow guarantees the truth of premise 1; but, at this point, it is not evident whether Descartes’ “clear and distinct” perception guarantees the truth of anything.

However, in the Fourth Meditation, Descartes goes to great lengths to guarantee the truth of whatever is clearly and distinctly understood. This veridical guarantee is based on the theses that God exists and that he cannot be a deceiver. These arguments, though very interesting, are numerous and complex, and so they will not be discussed here. Suffice it to say that since Descartes believes he has established God’s inability to deceive with absolute, geometrical certainty, he would have to consider anything contradicting this conclusion to be false. Moreover, Descartes claims that he cannot help but believe clear and distinct ideas to be true. However, if God put a clear and distinct idea in him that was false, then he could not help but believe a falsehood to be true and, to make matters worse, he would never be able to discover the mistake. Since God would be the author of this false clear and distinct idea, he would be the source of the error and would, therefore, be a deceiver, which must be false. Hence, all clear and distinct ideas must be true, because it is impossible for them to be false given God’s non-deceiving nature.

That said, the clarity and distinctness of Descartes’ understanding of mind and body guarantees the truth of premise 1. Hence, both “clear and distinct” premises are not blunt, unjustified assertions of what he believes but have very strong rational support from within Descartes’ system. However, if it turns out that God does not exist or that he can be a deceiver, then all bets are off. There would then no longer be any veridical guarantee of what is clearly and distinctly understood and, as a result, the first premise could be false. Consequently, premise 1 would not bar the possibility of minds requiring brains to exist and, therefore, this premise would not be absolutely certain as Descartes supposed. In the end, the conclusion is established with absolute certainty only when considered from within Descartes’ own epistemological framework but loses its force if that framework turns out to be false or when evaluated from outside of it.

These guaranteed truths express some very important points about Descartes’ conception of mind and body. Notice that mind and body are defined as complete opposites. This means that the ideas of mind and body represent two natures that have absolutely nothing in common. And, it is this complete diversity that establishes the possibility of their independent existence. But, how can Descartes make a legitimate inference from his independent understanding of mind and body as completely different things to their independent existence? To answer this question, recall that every idea of limited or finite things contains the idea of possible or contingent existence, and so Descartes is conceiving mind and body as possibly existing all by themselves without any other creature. Since there is no doubt about this possibility for Descartes and given the fact that God is all powerful, it follows that God could bring into existence a mind without a body and vice versa just as Descartes clearly and distinctly understands them. Hence, the power of God makes Descartes’ perceived logical possibility of minds existing without bodies into a metaphysical possibility. As a result, minds without bodies and bodies without minds would require nothing besides God’s concurrence to exist and, therefore, they are two really distinct substances.

The Second Version

The argument just examined is formulated in a different way later in the Sixth Meditation:

[T]here is a great difference between the mind and the body, inasmuch as the body is by its very nature always divisible, while the mind is utterly indivisible. For when I consider the mind, or myself in so far as I am merely a thinking thing, I am unable to distinguish any parts within myself; I understand myself to be something quite single and complete….By contrast, there is no corporeal or extended thing that I can think of which in my thought I cannot easily divide into parts; and this very fact makes me understand that it is divisible. This one argument would be enough to show me that the mind is completely different from the body…. (AT VII 86-87: CSM II 59).

This argument can be reformulated as follows, replacing “mind” for “I” as in the first version:

I understand the mind to be indivisible by its very nature.
I understand body to be divisible by its very nature.
Therefore, the mind is completely different from the body.

Notice the conclusion that mind and body are really distinct is not explicitly stated but can be inferred from 3. What is interesting about this formulation is how Descartes reaches his conclusion. He does not assert a clear and distinct understanding of these two natures as completely different but instead makes his point based on a particular property of each. However, this is not just any property but a property each has “by its very nature.” Something’s nature is just what it is to be that kind of thing, and so the term “nature” is here being used as synonymous with “essence.” On this account, extension constitutes the nature or essence of bodily kinds of things; while thinking constitutes the nature or essence of mental kinds of things. So, here Descartes is arguing that a property of what it is to be a body, or extended thing, is to be divisible, while a property of what it is to be a mind or thinking thing is to be indivisible.

Descartes’ line of reasoning in support of these claims about the respective natures of mind and body runs as follows. First, it is easy to see that bodies are divisible. Just take any body, say a pencil or a piece of paper, and break it or cut it in half. Now you have two bodies instead of one. Second, based on this line of reasoning, it is easy to see why Descartes believed his nature or mind to be indivisible: if a mind or an “I” could be divided, then two minds or “I’s” would result; but since this “I” just is my self, this would be the same as claiming that the division of my mind results in two selves, which is absurd. Therefore, the body is essentially divisible and the mind is essentially indivisible: but how does this lead to the conclusion that they are completely different?

Here it should be noted that a difference in just any non-essential property would have only shown that mind and body are not exactly the same. But this is a much weaker claim than Descartes’ conclusion that they are completely different. For two things could have the same nature, for example, extension, but have other, changeable properties or modes distinguishing them. Hence, these two things would be different in some respect, for example, in shape, but not completely different, since both would still be extended kinds of things. Consequently, Descartes needs their complete diversity to claim that he has completely independent conceptions of each and, in turn, that mind and body can exist independently of one another.

Descartes can reach this stronger conclusion because these essential properties are contradictories. On the one hand, Descartes argues that the mind is indivisible because he cannot perceive himself as having any parts. On the other hand, the body is divisible because he cannot think of a body except as having parts. Hence, if mind and body had the same nature, it would be a nature both with and without parts. Yet such a thing is unintelligible: how could something both be separable into parts and yet not separable into parts? The answer is that it can’t, and so mind and body cannot be one and the same but two completely different natures. Notice that, as with the first version, mind and body are here being defined as opposites. This implies that divisible body can be understood without indivisible mind and vice versa. Accordingly each can be understood as existing all by itself: they are two really distinct substances.

However, unlike the first version, Descartes does not invoke the doctrine of clear and distinct ideas to justify his premises. If he had, this version, like the first, would be absolutely certain from within Descartes’ own epistemological system. But if removed from this apparatus, it is possible that Descartes is mistaken about the indivisibility of the mind, because the possibility of the mind requiring a brain to exist would still be viable. This would mean that, since extension is part of the nature of mind, it would, being an extended thing, be composed of parts and, therefore, it would be divisible. As a result, Descartes could not legitimately reach the conclusion that mind and body are completely different. This would also mean that the further, implicit conclusion that mind and body are really distinct could not be reached either. In the end, the main difficulty with Descartes’ real distinction argument is that he has not adequately eliminated the possibility of minds being extended things like brains.

4. The Mind-Body Problem

The real distinction of mind and body based on their completely diverse natures is the root of the famous mind-body problem: how can these two substances with completely different natures causally interact so as to give rise to a human being capable of having voluntary bodily motions and sensations? Although several versions of this problem have arisen over the years, this section will be exclusively devoted to the version of it Descartes confronted as expressed by Pierre Gassendi, the author of the Fifth Objections, and Descartes’ correspondent, Princess Elizabeth of Bohemia. Their concern arises from the claim at the heart of the real distinction argument that mind and body are completely different or opposite things.

The complete diversity of their respective natures has serious consequences for the kinds of modes each can possess. For instance, in the Second Meditation, Descartes argues that he is nothing but a thinking thing or mind, that is, Descartes argues that he is a “thing that doubts, understands, affirms, denies, is willing, is unwilling, and also imagines and has sensory perceptions” (AT VII 28: CSM II 19). It makes no sense to ascribe such modes to entirely extended, non-thinking things like stones, and therefore, only minds can have these kinds of modes. Conversely, it makes no sense to ascribe modes of size, shape, quantity and motion to non-extended, thinking things. For example, the concept of an unextended shape is unintelligible. Therefore, a mind cannot be understood to be shaped or in motion, nor can a body understand or sense anything. Human beings, however, are supposed to be combinations of mind and body such that the mind’s choices can cause modes of motion in the body, and motions in certain bodily organs, such as the eye, cause modes of sensation in the mind.

The mind’s ability to cause motion in the body will be addressed first. Take for example a voluntary choice, or willing, to raise one’s hand in class to ask a question. The arm moving upward is the effect while the choice to raise it is the cause. But willing is a mode of the non-extended mind alone, whereas the arm’s motion is a mode of the extended body alone: how can the non-extended mind bring about this extended effect? It is this problem of voluntary bodily motion or the so-called problem of “mind to body causation” that so troubled Gassendi and Elizabeth. The crux of their concern was that in order for one thing to cause motion in another, they must come into contact with one another as, for example, in the game of pool the cue ball must be in motion and come into contact with the eight-ball in order for the latter to be set in motion. The problem is that, in the case of voluntarily bodily movements, contact between mind and body would be impossible given the mind’s non-extended nature. This is because contact must be between two surfaces, but surface is a mode of body, as stated at Principles of Philosophy part II, section 15. Accordingly, the mind does not have a surface that can come into contact with the body and cause it to move. So, it seems that if mind and body are completely different, there is no intelligible explanation of voluntary bodily movement.

Although Gassendi and Elizabeth limited themselves to the problem of voluntary bodily movement, a similar problem arises for sensations, or the so-called problem of “body to mind causation.” For instance, a visual sensation of a tree is a mode of the mind alone. The cause of this mode would be explained by the motion of various imperceptible bodies causing parts of the eye to move, then movements in the optic nerve, which in turn cause various “animal spirits” to move in the brain and finally result in the sensory idea of the tree in the mind. But how can the movement of the “animal spirits,” which were thought to be very fine bodies, bring about the existence of a sensory idea when the mind is incapable of receiving modes of motion given its non-extended nature? Again, since the mind is incapable of having motion and a surface, no intelligible explanation of sensations seems possible either. Therefore, the completely different natures of mind and body seem to render their causal interaction impossible.

The consequences of this problem are very serious for Descartes, because it undermines his claim to have a clear and distinct understanding of the mind without the body. For humans do have sensations and voluntarily move some of their bodily limbs and, if Gassendi and Elizabeth are correct, this requires a surface and contact. Since the mind must have a surface and a capacity for motion, the mind must also be extended and, therefore, mind and body are not completely different. This means the “clear and distinct” ideas of mind and body, as mutually exclusive natures, must be false in order for mind-body causal interaction to occur. Hence, Descartes has not adequately established that mind and body are two really distinct substances.

5. Descartes’ Response to the Mind-Body Problem

Despite the obviousness of this problem, and the amount of attention given to it, Descartes himself never took this issue very seriously. His response to Gassendi is a telling example:

These questions presuppose amongst other things an explanation of the union between the soul and the body, which I have not yet dealt with at all. But I will say, for your benefit at least, that the whole problem contained in such questions arises simply from a supposition that is false and cannot in any way be proved, namely that, if the soul and the body are two substances whose nature is different, this prevents them from being able to act on each other (AT VII 213: CSM II 275).

So, Descartes’ response to the mind-body problem is twofold. First, Descartes contends that a response to this question presupposes an explanation of the union between the mind (or soul) and the body. Second, Descartes claims that the question itself stems from the false presupposition that two substances with completely different natures cannot act on each other. Further examination of these two points will occur in reverse order.

Descartes’ principles of causation put forward in the Third Meditation lie at the heart of this second presupposition. The relevant portion of this discussion is when Descartes argues that the less real cannot cause something that is more real, because the less real does not have enough reality to bring about something more real than itself. This principle applies on the general level of substances and modes. On this account, an infinite substance, that is, God, is the most real thing because only he requires nothing else in order to exist; created, finite substances are next most real, because they require only God’s creative and conservative activity in order to exist; and finally, modes are the least real, because they require a created substance and an infinite substance in order to exist. So, on this principle, a mode cannot cause the existence of a substance since modes are less real than finite substances. Similarly, a created, finite substance cannot cause the existence of an infinite substance. But a finite substance can cause the existence of another finite substance or a mode (since modes are less real than substances). Hence, Descartes’ point could be that the completely diverse natures of mind and body do not violate this causal principle, since both are finite substances causing modes to exist in some other finite substance. This indicates further that the “activity” of the mind on the body does not require contact and motion, thereby suggesting that mind and body do not bear a mechanistic causal relation to each other. More will be said about this below.

The first presupposition concerns an explanation of how the mind is united with the body. Descartes’ remarks about this issue are scattered across both his published works and his private correspondence. These texts indicate that Descartes did not maintain that voluntary bodily movements and sensation arise because of the causal interaction of mind and body by contact and motion. Rather, he maintains a version of the form-matter theory of soul-body union endorsed by some of his scholastic-Aristotelian predecessors and contemporaries. Although a close analysis of the texts in question cannot be conducted here, a brief summary of how this theory works for Descartes can be provided.

Before providing this summary, however, it is important to disclaim that this scholastic-Aristotelian interpretation is a minority position amongst Descartes scholars. The traditional view maintains that Descartes’ human being is composed of two substances that causally interact in a mechanistic fashion. This traditional view led some of Descartes’ successors, such as Malebranche and Leibniz (who also believed in the real distinction of mind and body), to devise metaphysical systems wherein mind and body do not causally interact despite appearances to the contrary. Other philosophers considered the mind-body problem to be insurmountable, thereby denying their real distinction: they claim that everything is either extended (as is common nowadays) or mental (as George Berkeley argued in the 18th century). Indeed, this traditional, mechanistic interpretation of Descartes is so deeply ingrained in the minds of philosophers today, that most do not even bother to argue for it. However, a notable exception is Marleen Rozemond, who argues for the incompatibility of Descartes’ metaphysics with any scholastic-Aristotelian version of mind or soul-body union. Those interested in closely examining her arguments should consult her book Descartes’s Dualism. A book arguing in favor of the scholastic-Aristotelian interpretation is entitled Descartes and the Metaphysics of Human Nature; Chapter 5 specifically addresses Rozemond’s concerns.

Two major stumbling blocks Rozemond raises for the scholastic-Aristotelian interpretation concern the mind’s status as a substantial form and the extent to which Descartes can maintain a form of the human body. However, recall that Descartes rejects substantial forms because of their final causal component. Descartes’ argument was based on the fact (as he understood it) that the scholastics were ascribing mental properties to entirely non-mental things like stones. Since the mind is an entirely mental thing, these arguments just do not apply to it. Hence, Descartes’ particular rejection of substantial forms does not necessarily imply that Descartes did not view the mind as a substantial form. Indeed, as Paul Hoffman noted:

Descartes really rejects the attempt to use the human soul as a model for explanations in the entirely physical world. This makes it possible that Descartes considered the human mind to be the only substantial form. At first glance this may seem ad hoc but it is also important to notice that rejecting the existence of substantial forms with the exception of the mind or rational soul was not uncommon amongst Descartes’ contemporaries.

Although the mind’s status as a substantial form may seem at risk because of its meager explicit textual support, Descartes suggests that the mind a “substantial form” twice in a draft of open letter to his enemy Voetius:

Yet, if the soul is recognized as merely a substantial form, while other such forms consist in the configuration and motion of parts, this very privileged status it has compared with other forms shows that its nature is quite different from theirs (AT III 503: CSMK 207-208).

Descartes then remarks “this is confirmed by the example of the soul, which is the true substantial form of man” (AT III 508: CSMK 208). Although other passages do not make this claim explicitly, they do imply (in some sense) that the mind is a substantial form. For instance, Descartes claims in a letter to Mesland dated 9 February 1645, that the soul is “substantially united” with the human body (AT IV 166: CSMK 243). This “substantial union” was a technical term amongst the scholastics denoting the union between a substantial form and matter to form a complete substance. Consequently, there is some reason for believing that the human mind is the only substantial form left standing in Descartes’ metaphysics.

Another major stumbling block recognized by Rozemond is the extent to which, if any, Descartes’ metaphysics can maintain a principle for organizing extension into a human body. This was a point of some controversy amongst the scholastics themselves. Philosophers maintaining a Thomistic position argued that the human soul is the human body’s principle of organization. While others, maintaining a basically Scotistic position, argued that some other form besides the human soul is the form of the body. This “form of corporeity” organizes matter for the sake of being a human body but does not result in a full-fledged human being. Rather it makes a body with the potential for union with the human soul. The soul then actualizes this potential resulting in a complete human being. If Descartes did hold a fundamentally scholastic theory of mind-body union, then is it more Thomistic or Scotistic? Since intellect and will are the only faculties of the mind, it does not have the faculty for organizing matter for being a human body. So, if Descartes’ theory is scholastic, it must be most in line with some version of the Scotistic theory. Rozemond argues that Descartes’ rejection of all other substantial forms (except the human mind or soul) precludes this kind of theory since he cannot appeal to the doctrine of substantial forms like the Scotists.

Although Descartes argues that bodies, in the general sense, are constituted by extension, he also maintains that species of bodies are determined by the configuration and motion of their parts. This doctrine of “configuration and motion of parts” serves the same purpose as the doctrine of substantial forms with regards to entirely physical things. But the main difference between the two is that Descartes’ doctrine does not employ final causes. Recall that substantial forms organize matter for the purpose of being a species of thing. The purpose of a human body endowed with only the form of corporeity is union with the soul. Hence, the organization of matter into a human body is an effect that is explained by the final cause or purpose of being disposed for union. But, on Descartes’ account, the explanatory order would be reversed: a human body’s disposition for union is an effect resulting from the configuration and motion of parts. So, even though Descartes does not have recourse to substantial forms, he still has recourse to the configuration of matter and to the dispositions to which it gives rise, including “all the dispositions required to preserve that union” (AT IV 166: CSMK 243). Hence, on this account, Descartes gets what he needs, namely, Descartes gets a body properly configured for potential union with the mind, but without recourse to the scholastic notion of substantial forms with their final causal component.

Another feature of this basically Scotistic position is that the soul and the body were considered incomplete substances themselves, while their union results in one, complete substance. Surely Descartes maintains that mind and body are two substances but in what sense, if any, can they be considered incomplete? Descartes answers this question in the Fourth Replies. He argues that a substance may be complete insofar as it is a substance but incomplete insofar as it is referred to some other substance together with which it forms yet some third substance. This can be applied to mind and body as follows: the mind insofar as it is a thinking thing is a complete substance, while the body insofar as it is an extended thing is a complete substance, but each taken individually is only an incomplete human being.

This account is repeated in the following excerpt from a letter to Regius dated December 1641:

For there you said that the body and the soul, in relation to the whole human being, are incomplete substances; and it follows from their being incomplete that what they constitute is a being through itself (that is, an ens per se; AT III 460: CSMK 200).

The technical sense of the term “being through itself” was intended to capture the fact that human beings do not require any other creature but only God’s concurrence to exist. Accordingly, a being through itself, or ens per se, is a substance. Also notice that the claim in the letter to Regius that two incomplete substances together constitute a being through itself is reminiscent of Descartes’ remarks in the Fourth Replies. This affinity between the two texts indicates that the union of mind and body results in one complete substance or being through itself. This just means that mind and body are the metaphysical parts (mind and body are incomplete substances in this respect) that constitute one, whole human being, which is a complete substance in its own right. Hence, a human being is not the result of two substances causally interacting by means of contact and motion, as Gassendi and Elizabeth supposed, but rather they bear a relation of act and potency that results in one, whole and complete substantial human being.

This sheds some light on why Descartes thought that an account of mind-body union would put Gassendi’s and Elizabeth’s concerns to rest: they misconceived the union of mind and body as a mechanical relation when in fact it is a relation of act and potency. This avoids Gassendi’s and Elizabeth’s version of this problem. This aversion is accomplished by the fact that modes of voluntary motion (and sensations, by extrapolation) should be ascribed to a whole human being and not to the mind or the body taken individually. This is made apparent in a 21 May 1643 letter to Elizabeth where Descartes distinguishes between various “primitive notions.” The most general are the notions of being, number, duration, and so on, which apply to all conceivable things. He then goes on to distinguish the notions of mind and body:

Then, as regards body in particular, we have only the notion of extension, which entails the notions of shape and motion; and as regards the soul on its own, we have only the notion of thought, which includes the perceptions of the intellect and the inclinations of the will (AT III 665: CSMK 218).

Here body and soul (or mind) are primitive notions and the notions of their respective modes are the notions “entailed by” or “included in” these primitives. Descartes then discusses the primitive notion of mind-body union:

Lastly, as regards the soul and the body together, we have only the notion of their union, on which depends our notion of the soul’s power to move the body, and the body’s power to act on the soul and cause its sensations and passions (AT III 665: CSMK 218).

In light of the immediately preceding lines, this indicates that voluntary bodily movements and sensations are not modes of the body alone, or the mind alone, but rather are modes of “the soul and the body together.” This is at least partially confirmed in the following lines from Principles, part I, article 48:

But we also experience within ourselves certain other things, which must not be referred either to the mind alone or to the body alone. These arises, as will be made clear in the appropriate place, from the close and intimate union of our mind with the body. This list includes, first, appetites like hunger and thirds; secondly, the emotions or passions . . . (AT VIIIA 23: CSM I 209).

These texts indicate that the mind or soul is united with the body so as to give rise to another whole complete substance composed of these two metaphysical parts. And, moreover, this composite substance now has the capacity for having modes of its own, namely, modes of voluntary bodily movement and sensation, which neither the mind nor the body can have individually. So, voluntary bodily movements are not modes of the body alone caused by the mind, nor are sensations modes of the mind alone caused by the body. Rather, both are modes of a whole and complete human being. On this account, it makes no sense to ask how the non-extended mind can come into contact with the body to cause these modes. To ask this would be to get off on the wrong foot entirely, since contact between these two completely diverse substances is not required for these modes to exist. Rather all that is necessary is for the mind to actualize the potential in a properly disposed human body to form one, whole, human being to whom is attributed modes of voluntary movement and sensation.

Although the scholastic-Aristotelian interpretation avoids the traditional causal interaction problem based on the requirements of contact and motion, it does run up against another version of that problem, namely, a problem of formal causation. This is a problem facing any scholastic-Aristotelian theory of mind or soul-body union where the soul is understood to be an immaterial substantial form. Recall that the immaterial mind or soul as substantial form is suppose to act on a properly disposed human body in order to result in a full-fledged human being. The problem of formal causal interaction is: how can an immaterial soul assubstantial form act on the potential in a material thing? Can any sense be made of the claim that a non-extended or immaterial things acts on anything? Descartes noticed in a letter to Regius (AT III 493: CSMK 206) that the scholastics did not try to answer this question and so he and Regius need not either. The likely explanation of their silence is that the act-potency relation was considered absolutely fundamental to scholastic-Aristotelian philosophy and, therefore, it required no further explanation. So, in the end, even if Descartes’ theory is as described here, it does not evade all the causal problems associated with uniting immaterial souls or mind to their respective bodies. , However, if this proposed account is true, it helps to cast Descartes’ philosophy in a new light and to redirect the attention of scholars to the formal causal problems involved.

6. References and Further Reading

Primary Sources

Descartes, Rene, Ouevres de Descartes, 11 vols., eds. Charles Adam and Paul Tannery, Paris: Vrin, 1974-1989.
- This is still the standard edition of all of Descartes’ works and correspondence in their original languages. Cited in the text as AT, volume, page.
Descartes, Rene, The Philosophical Writings of Descartes, 3 vols., trans. John Cottingham, Robert Stoothoff, Dugald Murdoch and Anthony Kenny, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1984-1991
- This is the standard English translation of Descartes philosophical works and correspondence. Cited in the text as CSM or CSMK, volume, page.

Secondary Sources

Broughton, Janet and Mattern, Ruth, “Reinterpreting Descartes on the Notion of the Union of Mind and Body,” Journal of the History of Philosophy 16 (1978), 23-32.
- A reinterpretation of the notion of mind-body union in the correspondence with Elizabeth, which addresses Radner’s interpretation of it. See below.
Garber, Daniel, “Understanding Interaction: What Descartes Should Have Told Elizabeth,” Southern Journal of Philosophy, Supp. 21 (1983), 15-32.
- Article addressing the issues of the primitive notions and how this theory should be used to explain mind-body causal interaction to Elizabeth.
Hoffman, Paul, “The Unity of Descartes’ Man,” The Philosophical Review 95 (1986), 339-369.
- Article arguing that Descartes’ theory of mind-body union is more in line with scholastic-Aristotelian theories of soul-body union than previously supposed.
Kenny, Anthony, Descartes: A Study of His Philosophy, New York: Random House, 1968. See especially chapters 4 and 10.
- These chapters provide classic interpretations of the real distinction between mind and body and the mind-body problem.
Mattern, Ruth, “Descartes’ Correspondence with Elizabeth Concerning both the Union and Distinction of Mind and Body” in Descartes: Critical and Interpretive Essays, ed. Michael Hooker, Baltimore: John Hopkins University Press, 1978, 212-222.
- Short essay examining Descartes’ correspondence with Elizabeth on this issue and how it was supposed to direct her to a correct understanding of mind-body causal interaction.
Radner, Daisie, “Descartes’ Notion of the Union of Mind and Body,” Journal of the History of Philosophy 9 (1971), 159-170.
- This is the first article in Anglo-American scholarship to address the issue of mind-body union. It addresses several texts, including the letter to Elizabeth enumerating the primitive notions.
Rozemond, Marleen, Descartes’s Dualism, Cambridge: Harvard University Press, 1998.
- This book argues for a particular understanding of the real distinction between mind and body that would preclude Hoffman’s scholastic-Aristotelian account of their union.
Skirry, Justin, Descartes and the Metaphysics of Human Nature, London and New York: Thoemmes-Continuum Press, 2005.
- This book takes issue with Rozemond’s account of the mind-body union through a close re-examination of fundamental features of Descartes’ metaphysics and by building on certain features of Hoffman’s account.
Voss, Stephen, “Descartes: The End of Anthropology” in Reason, Will and Sensation, ed. John Cottingham, Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1994.
- This essay provides a close textual analysis of Descartes’ account of the union of mind and body on the supposition that he maintained a Platonic rather than scholastic-Aristotelian theory of mind-body union.
Williams, Bernard, Descartes: The Project of Pure Enquiry, Sussex: Harvester Press, 1978. See especially chapter 4.
- This is another classic account of the mind-body relation in Descartes.
Wilson, Margaret, Descartes, London and Boston: Routledge and Kegan Paul, 1978.
- Provides classic accounts of the real distinction argument and issues concerning mind-body causal interaction.

Author Information

Justin Skirry
Email: jskirry@yahoo.com
U. S. A.

Praise and Blame

Joel Feinberg observed that “moral responsibility… is a subject about which we are all confused” (1970: 37). Perhaps nowhere is this confusion more evident than in our understandings of praise and blame. This entry will contrast three influential philosophical accounts of our everyday practices of praise and blame, in terms of how they might be justified. On the one hand, a broadly Kantian approach sees responsibility for actions as relying on forms of self-control that point back to the idea of free will. On this account praise and blame are justified because a person freely chooses her actions. Praise and blame respond to the person as the chooser of her deed; they recognize her dignity as a rational agent, as Kantians tend to put it. This approach sharply contrasts with two further ways of thinking about the issues. One is utilitarian, where praise and blame are justified in terms of their social benefits. Another, more complex approach is roughly Aristotelian. This approach situates practices of praise and blame in terms of our on-going relationships with one another. This approach stresses the importance of mutual accountability, moral education, and assessments of character in terms of the many vices and virtues.

Introduction
The Problem of Free Will
Two Contrasting Approaches
1. The Utilitarian Account
2. The Aristotelian Account
The Kantian Account and Moral Worth
The Idea of Moral Worth
Conclusion
References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

This article will not try to convey the exact details of these accounts, but to show how these ways of looking at mutual accountability capture important parts of our everyday commonsense. One modern commentator claimed that, in our attitudes to moral responsibility, “we are all Kantians now” – by “we” meaning not just philosophers but all Western persons (Adkins, 1960: 2). Another central figure in this debate, Bernard Williams, agrees that Kant captured a widespread tendency of modern moral thinking, but also claims that there exist important counter-tendencies in our actual practices of responsibility. For Williams, ancient Greek understandings are actually more realistic and helpful than the Kantian one. So far as our modern praising and blaming actually make sense, he claims, they are better captured by a (roughly) Aristotelian account.

There are some important differences between praise and blame that will not be central to this entry; in fact, blame will get the greatest attention here. This is partly because praise seems less problematic: misplaced blame is felt as deeply unfair, not least because being exposed to blame is unpleasant and costly in a way that being praised is not. But it is principally because blame has a closer connection than praise to matters of intense philosophical interest, including freedom, responsibility and desert. We often praise inanimate objects (such as art works or buildings) and animals (a loyal pet, for example), although we could not blame such entities, however deeply dissatisfied we felt with them. The focus of this article, however, will be upon entities that are clearly open to blame as well as praise: human beings.

What is blame, such that only human beings can be blamed? We are all familiar with resentment, reproach and accusation regarding a person’s past actions; likewise, we all know the sense of guilt, shame or indignation they can elicit. Philosophers differ on how far certain emotions may be central to blame (this relates to a wider dispute, regarding which emotions, if any, constitute a proper basis for moral action). What is clear is that blame suggests both responsibility and culpability. Here, responsibility only implies that the act can be identified with a person, such that she can reasonably be expected to respond for it in some way. That is, it does not necessarily imply fault, or culpability. This is the idea that the person is “in the wrong,” that fault somehow attaches to them so that they deserve blame. (Philosophers tend to describe this as “blameworthiness.”) What sense we should give to these ideas of culpability or desert, and what is necessary for us to think of a person as responsible: these are central issues for this entry.

For further aspects of responsibility, see the sister entry to this article, responsibility. Another article also examines the topic of free will in depth. Nonetheless, since Kant’s account begins with the question of free will, it is also necessary to say something about this straightaway. The entry will then set out the utilitarian and Aristotelian accounts, before returning to Kant’s theory. It concludes by discussing ideas of moral worth and desert that make Kant’s account so appealing.

2. The Problem of Free Will

The free will debate has become an old chestnut of modern philosophy. It is an intuitively plausible way of approaching the issues – familiar to many even before they encounter philosophical texts. It is perhaps surprising, then, that this debate is actually a rather modern one.

The basic gist is this: if I am to be responsible (really responsible) for my conduct, then it must be within my control. However, if it is true that every event in the universe is determined by causal laws, then this must be true of the events that constitute my actions. Therefore, my conduct cannot really be within my control; therefore, I am not really responsible for my conduct. Two conclusions immediately suggest themselves. One is that it is incoherent to praise or blame me – and everyone else – for our actions, because it is so difficult to doubt the causal well-orderedness of the universe. The alternative conclusion, scarcely more appealing, is that the human will somehow sits outside this causal framework – ie, we have free will – because it is unthinkable that our moral ideas be so desperately incoherent.

Both lines of thought are incompatibilist; that is, they see the ideas of responsibility involved in praise and blame as incompatible with the causal well-orderedness of the universe. But while both attract some limited support among philosophers, the overwhelming consensus now lies with compatibilism. This is simply the thesis that responsibility and causal order are compatible. Most philosophers agree that the alleged incompatibility results from some important confusions, although there is much less consensus about what these may be. At least one area of confusion is clear, however, and forms the central issue of this article: what sort of responsibility for conduct is involved in praise and blame? Several familiar points in the free will debate are helpful for approaching this.

In the first place, it is well-known that this debate does not turn on the truth of determinism as such. Determinism is the idea that every event is determined by fixed causal laws. Yet it may well be that every event is somehow random in origin. One interpretation of quantum physics claims that causal laws are the product of statistical regularities, while these regularities stem from a near infinite number of random events. So far as the human will is concerned, this makes no difference. If my conduct is the product of chance, this makes me no more responsible for it than does its being generated by causal laws. The point is that if I am to be blamed or praised, then I must control my conduct – not causal laws, nor mere chance, nor some particular combination of the two.

Second, the free will debate bears a disquieting similarity to an older controversy. In medieval philosophy it used to be asked how God’s omniscience – his knowledge of everything that has happened and will happen – could be reconciled with our being subject to his moral judgment (that is, being sent to heaven or to hell). If God knows what we will do then this seems to imply that it is already decided whether we will act well or badly. And this, in turn, suggests that it makes no sense to punish or reward us. Theologians developed various doctrines to overcome this difficulty, but few sound convincing to modern ears – perhaps because the problem itself is no longer a live one, even for most believers. However that may be, it is interesting that many modern versions of the debate seem to take at least one of the planks of Christian theology for granted: that individuals have wills that can be bad or good, usually now expressed in the terms of people’s “blameworthiness” or (less often) “praiseworthiness.”

In this way, the modern American philosopher Joel Feinberg ironically referred to “a moral bank account” that we carry through life, which sums up our moral credits and debits in a single sum (1970: 20). Whether or not such an “account” makes sense, it is at least clear that the idea of “the will” is by no means self-explanatory. For Kant, as we shall see, it was obvious that all my choices can be summed up in a single moral evaluation, whether I have a “good” or “bad” will. Kant is equivocal, however, as to whether only God might make this evaluation, or whether human beings might also form reasonable opinions on the matter. But especially if we take the point of view of mutual, human accountability, it is not obvious why we should believe any such single evaluation to be possible, or what role this evaluation might play in our individual or collective lives. Certainly, we usually praise and blame in terms of particular actions and particular vices and virtues – not a good or bad will.

Third, this way of framing the issues creates a problematic gulf between normal moral agents (adult human beings of sound mind) and other creatures – animals and children. At some stage of evolution, and at some stage toward maturity, certain animals become “free,” when before they had all been determined in their conduct. Although it is grossly implausible that there are no relevant moral differences between the other animals, children, and human adults, it is no more plausible that the free will simply pops into existence at a certain stage of human development. (Within a Christian framework this issue was less problematic: human beings, and only human beings, have souls.) Nonetheless, we tend to think there is something sufficiently distinctive about human action, so that many non-religious people find the idea of free will plausible, and almost everyone assumes that blame (if not praise) only makes sense with regard to (mature?) human beings.

Taking the last three points together generates a further point. If the idea of the will is complex, and there is no straightforward moral dividing line between children and adults, between humans and other animals – together, these ideas suggest that a “will” is not something we all straightforwardly “have.” In other words: it is implausible that all adult humans have the same capacities, all to the same extent, that are involved in controlling action. One way of retaining the idea of the will might be to think of it as the bundle of capacities that are needed to control action in the light of moral concerns, these capacities being set only at such a level that all adult human beings of sound mind really seem to possess them. But two points need to be kept in mind about such a strategy. First, it remains the case that people will vary in how far they possess such capacities, and this variation will largely be a product of upbringing and natural qualities – that is, not something within an individual’s own control. Second, the sort of ultimate control over one’s moral character supposed in Kant’s or similar “free will” accounts is unlikely to be vindicated in this way.

3. Two Contrasting Approaches

Two influential lines of thought oppose the idea that praise and blame relate to “free will,” the metaphysical idea that we are responsible for our action because they are controlled by us and not (simply) caused by the world around us. For the utilitarian, praise and blame, like all our other practices, can only be justified in terms of their social consequences. A more complex account was given by Aristotle, who shares the utilitarian’s sense that praise and blame have important social consequences, but also offers an extended account of how they relate to the capacities needed for moral action.

a. The Utilitarian Account

The utilitarian case is straightforward. Blame and praise encourage us to perform socially valuable actions and to avoid socially costly actions. If we know we will be blamed for greed or cruelty, for example, then we have powerful motives to avoid these. Praise and blame also involve us in making assessments of people’s strengths and weaknesses, which is important when it comes to deciding who should be entrusted with which tasks and responsibilities. The stingy person might make a good banker, but a bad organizer of social occasions.

This approach does seem to capture important truths: we want to encourage and discourage different sorts of activity, and we need to have a sense of what different people are good at. It also makes sense of why we don’t blame some actions, even if they had bad outcomes (even though, in principle, only outcomes matter to the utilitarian). If the bad outcome was not chosen by the person (for example, she was forced to act that way by someone else), then there is nothing to be gained from blaming them (much better to blame the person who forced her). Thus the utilitarian can accommodate the important fact that praise and blame relate to free action: but this need not be thought of in terms of metaphysical “free will,” but instead the compatibilist freedom involved in choosing one’s actions independently of others’ interference.

But the utilitarian account faces a simple objection: does it really provide for responsibility, still more culpability? For example, if we know that someone does not respond well to criticism, it seems that the utilitarian case for blame is undermined. We would do much better to flatter and cajole them into acting differently. Of course, the utilitarian might reply that this is often what we in fact do with such people. Further, he might add that we do still blame such people when we discuss their characters behind their backs, perhaps describing them as self-righteous or stubborn. What seems to be missing in this response, however, is the idea that the person deserves blame. They seem to deserve criticism in just the same way that a faulty machine or a cracked mug deserve criticism: it’s useful that everyone knows they’re faulty, but they can hardly be described as blameworthy. Especially when we move from blame to the question of sanctions or punishment, this lack of desert seems to present a real problem for the utilitarian account.

Utilitarians face a more complex criticism, which goes beyond the scope of this entry. Historically more concerned with the actions of government than individuals, utilitarianism never developed a realistic moral psychology – that is, very roughly, an account of what makes the decent person tick. This lack of attention has permitted some of the most devastating critique of utilitarianism, such as Bernard Williams’s and Susan Wolf’s. But if we want to understand responsibility, our capacity to accept praise and blame as well as our tendency to dole them out, then we need to have a fairly good picture of moral agency.

b. The Aristotelian Account

This is where Aristotle’s more complex account enters the story. The most famous discussion of when people can be praised and blamed for their actions remains Aristotle’s. As with the utilitarians, Aristotle saw no need to talk about praise and blame in terms of free will. Aristotle speaks of whether acts are voluntary, and whether we attribute them to a person or to other factors. Some have ascribed this way of framing the issues to a lack of moral or scientific sophistication on the part of the ancient Greeks. However, a number of modern philosophers, most prominently Bernard Williams and Martha Nussbaum, have suggested that an Aristotelian account is actually more coherent and sophisticated than those typical of modern philosophy – and, indeed, more coherent than our modern, “common sense” intuitions about moral responsibility.

At first glance, it looks as if Aristotle takes it for granted that we are responsible for our actions, so that others can reasonably praise or blame or punish us. What he does is to highlight various conditions that lessen or cancel our responsibility. He discusses force of events, threats and coercion, ignorance, intoxication and bad character. Yet, taken together, his account shows us the basic elements involved in being a person who can reasonably be praised or blamed.

The first limitation upon voluntary action that Aristotle discusses is force of circumstances. His well-known example concerns a ship caught in a storm; the sailors must throw goods overboard if the ship is not to sink (NE 1110a). In this case the action is not fully voluntary, and we would not blame the sailors for their actions. (Nor, of course, would we blame the storm: the undesirable consequence, the loss of the goods, must be chalked off as the product of natural causes, for which no one can be blamed.) Note that such cases are extreme examples of the force of necessity under which we always live – we are always constrained in our actions by circumstances, although we only tend to notice this when the constraint is sudden or unexpected. (If blame were to arise in such a situation, it would be where the sailors failed to take account of necessity, so that the ship and many aboard perished.)

In fact, it tends to be the interference of other people that causes us the most grief – and which really causes problems for responsibility attributions. Such interference can take many forms, but its paradigmatic forms are coercion and manipulation. Regarding coercion, Aristotle’s judgment is balanced. It depends on what action my coercer is demanding of me, and what threats he makes. Some actions are so heinous that we should be blamed for doing them, whatever we are threatened with (and whatever blame also attaches to our coercer) – thus Aristotle dismisses the idea that a man might be “compelled” to kill his mother (NE 1110a). This makes it clear that a central issue at stake in attributions of responsibility is the expectations that people have of one another. There are some forms of coercion we do not usually expect people to resist, but there are also some sorts of action that we think people should never undertake, regardless of such factors. In such cases praise and blame are clearly working to clarify and reinforce these expectations – in other words, they provide for a form of moral education.

Aristotle does not comment on manipulation, where other people lead us to a false view of our circumstances. But he does discuss ignorance of these circumstances, and how it undermines our responsibility. If we are ignorant of who someone is, for example – as was Oedipus, who did not know that the old man obstructing him was actually his father – we may commit acts we would otherwise abhor – thus Oedipus committed patricide, killing his own father. For Aristotle, such actions are not to be blamed (with the important provisos that the ignorance is not itself culpable and the action was otherwise justified). What decides good or bad character is how a person reacts when he finds out the truth – if we fail to regret our deeds, then we can certainly be blamed, even if the original choice was justifiable. Our regret about the deed shows that we want to disown it, and prepares us to make up for it as best we can. A lack of regret shows we are happy for the deed to have been done anyhow, even though we are now aware of facts that others think should have prevented us from acting that way.

This argument hints at an important point. For Aristotle, the moral judgment of the self may be quite different from the judgments of others. The actor should regret his action deeply but, as long as he does so, on-lookers should not blame, but rather pity or perhaps console him. If we suppose that both actor and on-looker are making a judgment about the actor’s moral worth this seems puzzlingly inconsistent. Yet Aristotle’s account has a different logic: The actor’s regret reveals his determination not to be associated with such an action. The on-lookers’ pity relates to their awareness that this “self-blame” is proper yet not earned; it is something that could fall upon anyone in the wrong circumstances. Simplifying, we could say that on-lookers make a positive judgment of the actor, based on his preparedness to make a negative judgment of himself. But this is not so paradoxical if we think of these judgments, not as relating to moral worth, but as preparations for action. Something has gone wrong, after all, and those affected seem to deserve some recompense. In such a situation, the actor will feel duty-bound to help put things right (perhaps to compensate, at any rate to apologise or show remorse). On-lookers, pitying rather than blaming, try to make his task easier, since the responsibility, in such a case, was not earned by the actor.

We have just discussed actions done in ignorance of the facts. But not every form of ignorance excuses; factual knowledge is very different from moral knowledge. What if a man did not know murder was wrong? Would this make his murders morally innocent? Aristotle says not: there are certain things we can and do expect people to know – above all, basic moral truths such as the wrongness of murder. But this knowledge is not as straightforward as it might appear: it must include a fairly good capacity to judge which sorts of killing count as murder. Nazi bureaucrat Adolf Eichmann organized the killing of thousands, without a sense of its wrongness. Aristotle is clear: such moral ignorance, an inability or failure to judge, excuses no adult. Eichmann should be held responsible for murder. But why should moral ignorance not excuse, when factual ignorance does? We must recognize that moral knowledge is actually rather different from factual knowledge. If a person is morally ignorant it is his whole character, his lasting ability to judge and act well, that is impaired – and presumably very difficult to set right. Isolated errors in factual knowledge, on the other hand, can be easily corrected. So long as we subsequently recognize and regret what we have done, factual mistakes involve no lasting corruption of character.

Still, if a person is morally ignorant it follows that they are unable to choose well. Aristotle agrees, arguing that those of settled bad character – be they morally ignorant or otherwise – are unable to make decent moral judgments. Does this mean that blame is incoherent or misplaced? He claims not. Even if the vicious person cannot now choose to act otherwise, there was a time when her vices were not fixed, when she could have chosen not to be vicious. Therefore, Aristotle says, she can be blamed. This is neat but rather unconvincing. Aristotle is famous for emphasising the importance of good upbringing and habituation, and presumably many vices are formed in childhood, before people have formed capacities for deliberating reasonably. Indeed, many vices undercut the capacity for rational deliberation. So it is a clear implication of Aristotle’s own account that the badly brought up person may never be in a position to choose not to be vicious. Note, further, that this move represents Aristotle at his most Kantian: blame is justified by reference to control, to a “could have done otherwise” – even when his own account of character formation suggests that such control probably never existed.

What are we to say, then, when a person seems unlikely to change: she appears quite settled in some particular vice, either because she cannot understand the criticism or because she is unable to alter her character or habits? Such cases are very common, and – unless we suppose that they are not morally deplorable – seem to undermine the modern assumption that blame must relate only to conduct under our control. (The same sort of argument can also be made with praise: a virtuous person might be quite unable to do certain things – commit cruelty, for example.) Clearly, if we think a character trait is really beyond alteration, by us or by the person concerned, our blaming won’t involve an attempt to reason with the person we condemn. But our condemnation might have another rationale: for example, to clarify what sort of standards we expect of others, or to signal our fellow-feeling with those who have been adversely affected by someone’s vices.

In sum, Aristotle’s account is not entirely self-consistent. Generally his focus is two-fold: upon the qualities of character revealed by acts, in terms of our overall moral expectations; and upon the responsibilities that must be born, given the effects of an action. For most of the time, his account proceeds without much reference to desert, and it is this neglect that seems to pose the chief difficulty for the Aristotelian story. It is interesting, then, that Aristotle himself sometimes suggests that bad qualities are to be blamed because they were originally subject to choice, even though this quasi-Kantian claim is not (on his own account of character formation) really supportable. Whether or not Aristotle should have made this argument, it does show how powerful is the thought that blame must be justified in terms of what the person herself chose – however long ago that choice supposedly was made.

Despite this, philosophers have returned to Aristotle’s account again and again to illuminate key ingredients of responsible agency.

The capacity to respond to others’ censure and encouragement, whether expressed emotionally (eg, as resentment) or in the more articulated forms of praise and blame.
A reasonable grasp of how actions are understood by people around us and how they affect others, including the need to share out responsibilities for “patching things up” where something has gone wrong. (That we praise and blame children, however, emphasises the educative and encouraging role that praise and blame play in developing such knowledge.)
Together with our own ability to express judgments of others, these capacities allow us to participate in forms of mutual accountability, whereby we inculcate and to some extent enforce shared standards of action.

This list is not comprehensive, but it serves to illustrate the underlying point of an Aristotelian account: our praising and blaming of one another rest on these sort of fairly basic capacities, which do not seem to demand any strong metaphysical elaboration. Indeed, if we approach the matter this way, the puzzle seems to be inverted. Not, “how might free will and determinism be reconciled?;” rather, “why should we feel there is a metaphysical issue at all?”

4. The Kantian Account and Moral Worth

We have seen that the Aristotelian and utilitarian accounts face a common criticism. Illuminating as they may be, they seem to pay too little attention to the question of desert, or culpability. Is the vicious person blameworthy? Does the person of good will, however much she is hindered by bad luck and hard circumstances, not deserve moral recognition? Our intuitions tend to answer such questions affirmatively. And the most usual justification is that the bad person has less moral worth than the person of good will, and therefore deserves blame and perhaps even punishment. A utitilitarian such as JJC Smart sees such justifications as “pharisaical” – that is, as hypocritically self-righteous, and encouraging of excessively moralistic forms of blame and retribution. But there is no denying the power and influence of such justifications.

The reason why so many people – within and without academic philosophy – feel the pull of the free will debate lies in the idea of moral worth we often associate with responsibility attributions such as blame. Galen Strawson expresses the core idea as follows: “if we have [true responsibility], then it makes sense, at least, to suppose that it might be just to punish some with eternal torment in hell, and reward others with eternal bliss in heaven” (1991: viii). Any such “ultimate” merit or demerit clearly has to be a matter of strictly individual desert. If it were merely a matter of chance who went to heaven or hell – or who would do so, if those fates really existed – this would plainly be a matter of mere fortune. Such intense good or bad luck would make the world even more morally arbitrary than it already is. If such merit is to be fairly allocated, therefore, it needs to be seen as something that lies within individuals’ own control. This line of thought, in turn, is based on what John Skorupski calls an “ideal of pure egalitarian desert” (1999: 156). Modern morality regards each person as equal in moral standing, as having an intrinsic dignity and deserving of equal respect. The thought is that we all equally possess control over our will, so that it makes sense to imagine everybody reaping an equally fair return on how well we exercise that control. (Clearly, this line of thought goes against the idea of the will referred to above, as a “bundle” of capacities unequally distributed among human beings.)

The thinker who grapples most systematically with these questions is Kant. He sees us all as equal in our capacity to strive for morality. But he knows that we don’t all do this, and claims that only some are worthy of happiness.

For Kant, our moral worth – the goodness of our will – is gauged by how sincerely and persistently we have sought to do our duty. To do our duty may be much harder for some people, for instance, those who have violent passions or who were brought up with bad habits. But moral worth is not about results; it is about the will. We all have such a will, an ability to choose well, despite the fact that some of us face stronger counter-inclinations or more difficult circumstances. To truly judge a person’s moral worth involves seeing past all the obstacles that their will has faced. Kant argues that this makes moral worth impossible for us to judge with any assurance; only God can see beyond all those things. This lack of knowledge corresponds to Kant’s main concern, which is how we judge ourselves. Our concern should be to do the right thing, and to do it because it is the right thing. To Kant it’s no problem that we’re never sure about others’ wills, and the obstacles or benefits they have faced. The point is that we can never be sure of our own motivations, and must always be attempting to do better in the future.

Moreover, Kant claims we are all equally well able to see what we should do. For Kant “even the most hardened scoundrel” would act morally, were it not for the opposing incentives of his inclinations and desires (Groundwork, 4:454). Kant needs to claim this because otherwise he would not be able to justify condemning people who suppose they are doing the right thing, when in fact their acts are quite wicked – the problem of the self-righteous wrong-doer. Adolf Eichmann, who we mentioned before, seems to have been sincere in thinking his acts were defensible (he even justified his actions with a twisted version of Kant’s moral philosophy!). Yet no one, and certainly not Kant, would doubt that he deserved the gravest condemnation for his crimes. In simplest form, the Kantian thought is that, if only we wanted to, we could all see that certain things are wrong – for example, no one could possibly want a world where everyone committed actions like Eichmann’s. Nonetheless, such examples are problematic for Kant, because it does seem implausible that people are equal in their capacities for moral knowledge. People’s sensitivity to different moral considerations is highly variable, and is clearly shaped by up-bringing and environment.

(By way of contrast, it may be worth noting that from an Aristotelian perspective, the realities of moral ignorance and moral disagreement pose no theoretical problems. In fact, they provide an important justification for praise and blame in terms of mutual accountability – that is, they help with moral learning by communicating when we have met or failed to meet moral standards. But because Kant’s account goes inward, to my scrutiny of my motives and intentions, he says remarkably little about this crucial educative aspect of responsibility attributions.)

Modern Kantian writers differ on how to deal with these two issues, the invisibility of the will and the claim that we share equal access to moral knowledge. One important line of thought is Christine Korsgaard’s. When we blame someone, she claims, we are recognising his capacity to reason about his conduct. Many people have felt that it is “enlightened” not to blame people for bad conduct, and instead to offer explanations that excuse or mitigate – for instance, by taking a person’s anti-social behaviour to have been caused by a bad childhood rather than a bad will. But Kantians insist that this is to deny someone recognition as a rational agent, as someone capable of choosing his action in the light of reasons. This corresponds to the important intuition that there is something patronising about making excuses for people, and not taking their own point of view seriously.

It is not clear whether blame, on this account, need have any link with the idea that someone’s will has proved defective; and it is this which is important if we are to give a place to culpability within the Kantian schema. Modern Kantians usually concede that Kant was too optimistic about our ability always to see the right thing to do. In this case, it is sometimes difficult for us to judge correctly, and so we have to work together at discovering the moral standards applicable in complex situations. Clearly, then, we need to communicate concerning the rights and wrongs of our individual actions. What this seems to omit, however, is the fact that desert is in play when we blame: blame often has an emotional content, and rarely sounds like a disinterested conversation about what would have been the right thing to do. One reason for this, in turn, is that we are identified by our acts, and tend to identify ourselves with them: if our acts are faulty, and none of the standard excusing conditions apply (such as factual ignorance, as discussed by Aristotle), so too must our character be, if blame is to be deserved. (On the other hand, perhaps it is true that we tend to “take things too personally.”)

This points to a real difficulty for Kantians. Moral evaluation is supposed to concern the will, not all the other complicated factors that have formed our character. (Aristotelians, and many others, reject the idea that such a separation can be made, even in theory.) Although Kantians think such a separation is theoretically possible, in practice they concede that we can only guess at the will. This seems to suggest that we should not blame one another, inasmuch as blame implies culpability, an individual failure to will rightly. But this leaves us with two unrealistic alternatives. One is that we explain bad conduct in terms of mitigating factors, which is plainly unattractive, for the very good Kantian reason that it fails to respect people as the choosers of their deeds. Yet the other obvious alternative, that instead of blame we should pursue an enlightened, as well as enlightening, conversation about correct responses to situations, is patently unreal. If people as we know them are going to change, or learn, by and large it will not be unemotional reasoning that alters them, but the many forces that speak to all aspects of character – for instance, resentment, shame, force of opinion. Yet, for all that these characteristic aspects of blame do not operate on the will (as Kantians conceive it), they certainly convey moral disapproval, and can be very effective.

5. The Idea of Moral Worth

The notion of moral worth central to Kant’s account is probably what one writer on ancient Greek ethics – AWH Adkins – had in mind when he said, “We are all Kantians now.” (1960: 2) Kant’s idea attractively reconciles two broad value judgments: (i) the egalitarian idea that all persons are moral equals by virtue of having freedom to choose morally; and (ii) the idea that responsibility relates to desert, so that people can nonetheless be judged very differently – some being condemned for their lives and characters, others praised. Although we have seen serious problems with the idea that people have an equal ability to choose well, most people agree that blame which attaches to parts of our character that we cannot control is deeply unfair. Does this mean, then, that we should accept a Kantian idea of moral worth, where praise and blame are understood as responses to people’s ultimate deserts?

To begin with, contrast Kant with Aristotle. Aristotle makes no claims about a person’s ultimate merit or demerit. People might be vicious or virtuous in various ways, and there might be rare paragons who possess a comprehensive set of virtues (yes, these are philosophers). Naturally we would not want to associate with the vicious, and naturally we will want to condemn their vices in no uncertain terms: It might help them to learn to do better, and it may caution others against them, and it should reinforce our own and other people’s sense of what character traits are desirable. But for Aristotle there is no sense that the vicious are earning a lasting form of discredit that should condemn them in the eyes of an ultimate judge. If the vicious person were to protest to Aristotle that the condemnations he faced were unfair, perhaps because his character had been shaped by his vicious parents, one suspects Aristotle would be rather unmoved. Life isn’t fair, he might say, and we certainly won’t make it fairer by pretending some vices are less real because of their origin in early childhood, let alone because of their fixity within an individual’s character. It may be unpleasant (he might continue) for you to hear this blame and condemnation – indeed, I’m glad that it is, because at least it shows that you are not so vicious that you don’t care about others’ opinions of you – but there are other matters at stake here, above all the standards and expectations which regulate all our lives together.

So Aristotle’s characteristic view is that some people just are better than others, in their abilities to choose rightly as in other regards. Given this “brute fact,” it is all the more important to give attention to mutual moral education and ensuring that people feel the need to take responsibility where things have gone wrong. Yet it does seem true that Aristotle paid too little attention to the question of desert. We can see this by recalling that he is not wholly consistent here. As we saw, he does try to justify our blame of the vicious person in terms of that person’s choice to become vicious, supposing that otherwise our condemnation would be unfair. Nonetheless, the main thrust of his account seems to be that Kant’s egalitarian fairness is not something we can really achieve.

On the other hand, it is difficult to deny the basic, very appealing intuition of Kant’s ethics: that people’s happiness should correspond to their moral worth – to the sincere intentions that are within everyone’s control. Apart from its appeal to fairness, this conception is also plausible because it corresponds well to several features of praise and blame. We do tend to judge the intent behind people’s actions, rather than the often haphazard results of their deeds. We take account of people’s circumstances, and judge less harshly where these place hard or immoral pressures on people. We also, quite often, feel that allowances should be made for the effects on character of abusive or deprived upbringings. In each case, we can interpret these concessions in Kantian terms – as drawing a distinction between the person’s will and the obstacles of circumstance, thus keeping our moral evaluation to what is within a person’s control – and, therefore, what concerns their deserts.

There are, however, reasons to doubt whether this Kantian interpretation is really the best account of these intuitions. The most obvious problem is that we often expect people to take responsibility for things they didn’t intend. This is not only in those cases where we judge that someone should have formed their intentions more carefully. Certainly we judge the negligent driver who causes an accident more harshly than a driver who was careful but nevertheless caused an accident. But even in the latter case, we expect the driver to bear important responsibilities. The problem that many of the things which attract moral culpability are wholly or partly outside of individual control is connected with the problem of moral luck. It is important to realise, however, that this problem is based on the Kantian idea that moral judgments, be it of character or future responsibilities, are deserved because they relate to a person’s “moral worth.”

Aristotle’s account offers a different way of understanding these everyday intuitions about when blame is justified. On his account we are judging the character of the person we are dealing with, based on how they act, how seriously they take their responsibilities, and how they respond to others’ responsibility attributions. To judge such questions we do indeed give a lot of weight to a person’s intentions: obviously, an intended action reveals a person’s character especially clearly. At the same time, we need to appreciate what he knew about the situation he was responding to, what pressures he was under, and special factors affecting his ability to deliberate and choose. Hence Aristotle’s concern with factual ignorance, force of circumstances, and intoxication; and we might note the more modern concern with mental illness. On an Aristotelian line, the point is that these factors alter the extent to which actions reveal the character of the person. That they undermine the person’s “control” is true, but subsidiary. To support this thought, we might consider how certain forms of bad character constitute a lack of control over one’s actions – thus the person who is weak-willed or indecisive, for example. Here weak-willed, indecisive action reveals the person, and her inability to control her actions.

This suggests that we do not need to accept Kant’s will-based view, where blame relates to moral worth. But we might still wonder if the other accounts can explain the culpability aspect of blame, the idea that it relates to desert.

Both utilitarians and Aristotelians can agree that at least one sense of desert clearly applies. A person deserves to be judged accurately, just as the facts deserve to be assessed truly, if they are to be assessed at all. As we need to judge one another, then clearly we deserve to be assessed fairly. But this doesn’t quite take us to the idea that a person has earned blame, for the fact is that a negative judgment of our character is unpleasant and costly. After all, human beings understand such judgments, and feel their effects, in a way that other entities do not.

There is another question of desert: praise raises the possibility of reward, while blame almost automatically suggests we ought to do something to make up for what we have done or how we have been. Moral philosophers continue to dispute whether utilitarians can give a proper account of this sort of responsibility. But we have already seen how Aristotle could respond. On his view responsibility attributions have a practical aspect: they are preparations for action. It is obvious that when something has gone wrong, we need to distribute the resulting responsibilities: who should pay compensation, apologise, or even be punished. If we take the view that there are always duties to be done, including making good when things have gone wrong, then the question is not what the results say about people’s moral worth, but rather how responsibilities for making good can be fairly divvied up.

But whether this is enough to justify the sense of desert that tends to attach to judgments of blame, or whether we tend to be too keen to invest blame with ideas of personal desert – these are questions much beyond the scope of this entry.

6. Conclusion

Praise and blame relate to our sense of people as capable of taking responsibility for their actions. As we saw, ideas about responsibility are usually presented in terms of a contest between two positions, compatibilism and incompatibilism. Incompatibilists accept the dilemma of free will versus determinism: responsibility depends on me controlling my actions, rather than other causal influences that operate around me. Praise, but especially blame, make no sense if determinism is true. Compatibilists, on the other hand, want to insist that the causal well-orderedness of the universe is, precisely, compatible with our responsibility for our actions. But for most philosophers the question is not whether responsibility and causal well-orderedness are compatible, but how. In other words, to adapt Adkins’s adage, “we are all compatibilists now.”

The essential issue for any compatibilist position lies in the conception of responsibility it relies on – an issue much less well-explored by philosophers than the metaphysics of freedom and determinism. This article has contrasted three broad schools of thought on how we put responsibility into practice, by praising and blaming one another. When Adkins claimed that “we are all Kantians now,” he was not referring to Kant’s (incompatibilist) metaphysics but rather to our tendency to feel that responsibility attributions must have depth, that they reflect something about a person’s “real” deserts. Yet this position leads us to claims about control over the self, to the idea of choices that are really ours and not the result of any external influence. In other words, it is more difficult than it may seem to separate Kant’s position from his metaphysical account of freedom and the incompatibilism which he, above all other writers, so strongly articulated.

The roughly Aristotelian alternative discussed here has been most influentially articulated in Bernard Williams’s critique of modern accounts of morality, which he thinks are most clearly expressed in Kant’s philosophy. Williams argues that these ideas neither make sense on their own terms, nor do they make sense of what we actually do when we do engage in attributions of responsibility. As we have seen, Aristotle’s account of praise and blame is based on: (i) how far acts reveal character; (ii) the fair distribution of responsibilities to act; and (iii) the attempt to exchange reasons, share standards, and maintain relationships with those whom we judge – and who judge us in turn.

What both the Aristotelian and utilitarian accounts lack is the deep thirst for equality and fairness which motivate Kant. Aristotle’s account provides no equivalent to the Kantian will – some moral quantity which all human beings possess and which grounds the idea of their equal worth. Nor does it really satisfy the widespread sense that moral judgment should offer fairness – even though the world does not. There is a deeply appealing sense of fairness in Kant’s concern to do justice to each person’s will, by isolating some moral core to the person independent of all formative and environmental factors. Even if wicked people prosper and the innocent suffer, our moral judgment of each constitutes a deep and subtle form of compensation: with regard to what really matters, the one is lacking while the other is undiminished. Even if goodness is made much harder for some, and its results may be correspondingly less, nonetheless we should try to see past those externals, once more, to what really matters.

To this, the Aristotelian and the utilitarian alike may say: to treat praise and blame as reflecting such a pure form of desert is to lose touch with what really matters about them. Praise and blame help us live together in a world where ultimate deserts are impossible to make out, if they exist at all. But just because we cannot make out people’s “moral worth,” it is still true that we need to take responsibility – not least, in our openness to one another’s praise and blame.

7. References and Further Reading

Adkins, AWH (1960) Merit and responsibility, Clarendon Press, Oxford.
Aristotle Nicomachean ethics (the most readable translation is Roger Crisp’s, Cambridge University Press, Cambridge, 2000).
Feinberg, Joel (1970) Doing and deserving: essays in the theory of responsibility (Princeton University Press, Princeton NJ).
- A set of classic essays on responsibility for action, including justifications of praise and blame.
Fingarette, Herbert (1967) On responsibility (Basic Books, New York).
- Another set of classic essays, including the argument that blame is intelligible insofar as it connects up with someone’s pre-existing concern for others.
Kant, Immanuel (1784) Groundwork to the metaphysics of morals (the best translation is Mary Gregor’s, Cambridge University Press, Cambridge, 1998).
Korsgaard, Christine (1996) “Creating the Kingdom of Ends: Reciprocity and Responsibility in Personal Relations” in her Creating the kingdom of ends (Cambridge University Press, Cambridge).
- A sophisticated Kantian account of praise and blame.
Skorupski, John (1999) “The definition of morality” in his Ethical explorations (Oxford University Press, Oxford).
Smart, J.J.C. (1961) “Free will, praise and blame” Mind 70, 291-306.
- A clear and succinct utilitarian account of praise and blame.
Smiley, Marion (1992) Moral responsibility and the boundaries of community: power and accountability from a pragmatic point of view (University of Chicago Press, Chicago).
- Criticises conventional discussions of freedom and determinism, claiming that they fail to investigate the idea of responsibility.
Strawson, Galen (1991) Freedom and belief (Clarendon, Oxford).
Strawson, Peter (1974) “Freedom and resentment” in his Freedom and resentment and other essays (Methuen, London).
- This famous essay resituates the free will debate by highlighting the importance of “reactive attitudes” such as resentment to interpersonal relations.
Williams, Bernard (1993) Shame and necessity (University of California Press, Berkeley CA) .
- A sustained argument that the ancient Greeks had a nuanced and sophisticated account of responsibility attributions.
Williams, Bernard (1995a) “How free does the will need to be?” in his Making sense of humanity and other philosophical papers, 1982-1993 (Cambridge University Press, Cambridge).
Williams, Bernard (1995b) “Voluntary acts and responsible agents,” in his Making sense of humanity.

Author Information

Garrath Williams
Email: g.d.Williams@lancaster.ac.uk
University of Lancaster
United Kingdom

Diogenes of Sinope (c. 404—323 B.C.E.)

diogenes_of_sinope The most illustrious of the Cynic philosophers, Diogenes of Sinope serves as the template for the Cynic sage in antiquity. An alleged student of Antisthenes, Diogenes maintains his teacher’s asceticism and emphasis on ethics, but brings to these philosophical positions a dynamism and sense of humor unrivaled in the history of philosophy. Though originally from Sinope, the majority of the stories comprising his philosophical biography occur in Athens, and some of the most celebrated of these place Alexander the Great or Plato as his foil.It is disputed whether Diogenes left anything in writing. If he did, the texts he composed have since been lost. In Cynicism, living and writing are two components of ethical practice, but Diogenes is much like Socrates and even Plato in his sentiments regarding the superiority of direct verbal interaction over the written account. Diogenes scolds Hegesias after he asks to be lent one of Diogenes’ writing tablets: “You are a simpleton, Hegesias; you do not choose painted figs, but real ones; and yet you pass over the true training and would apply yourself to written rules” (Diogenes Laertius, Lives of Eminent Philosophers, Book 6, Chapter 48). In reconstructing Diogenes’ ethical model, then, the life he lived is as much his philosophical work as any texts he may have composed.

Life
Philosophical Practice: A Socrates Gone Mad
References and Further Reading

1. Life

The exceptional nature of Diogenes’ life generates some difficulty for determining the exact events that comprise it. He was a citizen of Sinope who either fled or was exiled because of a problem involving the defacing of currency. Thanks to numismatic evidence, the adulteration of Sinopean coinage is one event about which there is certainty. The details of the defacing, though, are murkier: “Diocles relates that [Diogenes] went into exile because his father was entrusted with the money of the state and adulterated the coinage. But Eubulides in his book on Diogenes says that Diogenes himself did this and was forced to leave home along with his father” (Diogenes Laertius, Lives of Eminent Philosophers, Book 6, Chapter 20). Whether it was Diogenes or his father who defaced the currency, and for whatever reasons they may have done so, the act led to Diogenes’ relocation to Athens.

Diogenes’ biography becomes, historically, only sketchier. For example, one story claims that Diogenes was urged by the oracle at Delphi to adulterate the political currency, but misunderstood and defaced the state currency (Diogenes Laertius, Lives of Eminent Philosophers, Book 6, Chapter 20). A second version tells of Diogenes traveling to Delphi and receiving this same oracle after he had already altered the currency, turning his crime into a calling. It is, finally, questionable whether Diogenes ever consulted the oracle at all; the Delphic advice is curiously close to Socrates’ own injunction, and the interweaving of life and legend in Diogenes’ case is just as substantial.

Once in Athens, Diogenes famously took a tub, or a pithos, for an abode. In Lives of Eminent Philosophers, it is reported that Diogenes “had written to some one to try and procure a cottage for him. When this man was a long time about it, he took for his abode the tub in the Metroön, as he himself explains in his letters” (Diogenes Laertius, Book 6, Chapter 23). Apparently Diogenes discovered that he had no need for conventional shelter or any other “dainties” from having watched a mouse. The lesson the mouse teaches is that he is capable of adapting himself to any circumstance. This adaptability is the origin of Diogenes’ legendary askēsis, or training.

Diogenes Laertius reports that Diogenes of Sinope “fell in” with Antisthenes who, though not in the habit of taking students, was worn out by Diogenes’ persistence (Lives of Eminent Philosophers, Book 6, Chapter 22). Although this account has been met with suspicion, especially given the likely dates of Diogenes’ arrival in Athens and Antisthenes’ death, it supports the perception that the foundation of Diogenes’ philosophical practice rests with Antisthenes.

Another important, though possibly invented, episode in Diogenes’ life centers around his enslavement in Corinth after having been captured by pirates. When asked what he could do, he replied “Govern men,” which is precisely what he did once bought by Xeniades. He was placed in charge of Xeniades’ sons, who learned to follow his ascetic example. One story tells of Diogenes’ release after having become a cherished member of the household, another claims Xeniades freed him immediately, and yet another maintains that he grew old and died at Xeniades’ house in Corinth. Whichever version may be true (and, of course, they all could be false), the purpose is the same: Diogenes the slave is freer than his master, who he rightly convinces to submit to his obedience.

Though most accounts agree that he lived to be quite old— some suggesting he lived until ninety— the tales of Diogenes’ death are no less multiple than those of his life. The possible cause of death includes a voluntary demise by holding his breath, an illness brought on by eating raw octopus, or death by dog bite. Given the embellished feel of each of these reports, it is more likely that he died of old age.

2. Philosophical Practice: A Socrates Gone Mad

When Plato is asked what sort of man Diogenes is, he responds, “A Socrates gone mad” (Diogenes Laertius, Book 6, Chapter 54). Plato’s label is representative, for Diogenes’ adaptation of Socratic philosophy has frequently been regarded as one of degradation. Certain scholars have understood Diogenes as an extreme version of Socratic wisdom, offering a fascinating, if crude, moment in the history of ancient thought, but which ought not to be confused with the serious business of philosophy. This reading is influenced by the mixture of shamelessness and askēsis which riddle Diogenes’ biography. This understanding, though, overlooks the centrality of reason in Diogenes’ practice.

Diogenes’ sense of shamelessness is best seen in the context of Cynicism in general. Specifically, though, it stems from a repositioning of convention below nature and reason. One guiding principle is that if an act is not shameful in private, that same act is not made shameful by being performed in public. For example, it was contrary to Athenian convention to eat in the marketplace, and yet there he would eat for, as he explained when reproached, it was in the marketplace that he felt hungry. The most scandalous of these sorts of activities involves his indecent behavior in the marketplace, to which he responded “he wished it were as easy to relieve hunger by rubbing an empty stomach” (Diogenes Laertius, Lives of Eminent Philosophers, Book 6, Chapter 46).

He is labeled mad for acting against convention, but Diogenes points out that it is the conventions which lack reason: “Most people, he would say, are so nearly mad that a finger makes all the difference. For if you go along with your middle finger stretched out, some one will think you mad, but, if it’s the little finger, he will not think so” (Diogenes Laertius, Lives of Eminent Philosophers, Book 6, Chapter 35). In these philosophical fragments, reason clearly has a role to play. There is a report that Diogenes “would continually say that for the conduct of life we need right reason or a halter” (Diogenes Laertius, Lives of Eminent Philosophers, Book 6, Chapter 24). For Diogenes, each individual should either allow reason to guide her conduct, or, like an animal, she will need to be lead by a leash; reason guides one away from mistakes and toward the best way in which to live life. Diogenes, then, does not despise knowledge as such, but despises pretensions to knowledge that serve no purpose.

He is especially scornful of sophisms. He disproves an argument that a person has horns by touching his forehead, and in a similar manner, counters the claim that there is no such thing as motion by walking around. He elsewhere disputes Platonic definitions and from this comes one of his more memorable actions: “Plato had defined the human being as an animal, biped and featherless, and was applauded. Diogenes plucked a fowl and brought it into the lecture-room with the words, ‘Here is Plato’s human being.’ In consequence of which there was added to the definition, ‘having broad nails’” (Diogenes Laertius, Lives of Eminent Philosophers, Book 6, Chapter 40). Diogenes is a harsh critic of Plato, regularly disparaging Plato’s metaphysical pursuits and thereby signaling a clear break from primarily theoretical ethics.

Diogenes’ talent for undercutting social and religious conventions and subverting political power can tempt readers into viewing his position as merely negative. This would, however, be a mistake. Diogenes is clearly contentious, but he is so for the sake of promoting reason and virtue. In the end, for a human to be in accord with nature is to be rational, for it is in the nature of a human being to act in accord with reason. Diogenes has trouble finding such humans, and expresses his sentiments regarding his difficulty theatrically. Diogenes is reported to have “lit a lamp in broad daylight and said, as he went about, ‘I am searching for a human being’” (Diogenes Laertius, Lives of Eminent Philosophers, Book 6, Chapter 41).

For the Cynics, life in accord with reason is lived in accord with nature, and therefore life in accord with reason is greater than the bounds of convention and the polis. Furthermore, the Cynics claim that such a life is the life worth living. As a homeless and penniless exile, Diogenes experienced the greatest misfortunes of which the tragedians write, and yet he insisted that he lived the good life: “He claimed that to fortune he could oppose courage, to convention nature, to passion reason” (Diogenes Laertius, Lives of Eminent Philosophers, Book 6, Chapter 38).

3. References and Further Reading

Billerbeck, Margarethe. Die Kyniker in der modernen Forschung. Amsterdam: B.R. Grüner, 1991.
Branham, Bracht and Marie-Odile Goulet-Cazé, eds. The Cynics: The Cynic Movement in Antiquity and Its Legacy. Berkeley: University of California Press, 1996.
Dudley, D. R. A History of Cynicism from Diogenes to the 6th Century A.D. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1937.
Goulet-Cazé, Marie-Odile. L’Ascèse cynique: Un commentaire de Diogène Laërce VI 70-71, Deuxième édition. Paris: Libraire Philosophique J. VRIN, 2001.
Goulet-Cazé, Marie-Odile and Richard Goulet, eds. Le Cynisme ancien et ses prolongements. Paris: Presses Universitaires de France, 1993.
Diogenes Laertius. Lives of Eminent Philosophers Vol. I-II. Trans. R.D. Hicks. Cambridge: Harvard University Press, 1979.
Long, A.A. and David N. Sedley, eds. The Hellenistic Philosophers, Volume 1 and Volume 2. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1987.
Malherbe, Abraham J., ed. and trans. The Cynic Epistles. Missoula, Montana: Scholars Press, 1977.
Navia, Luis E. Diogenes of Sinope: The Man in the Tub. Westport, Connecticut: Greenwood Press, 1990.
Navia, Luis E. Classical Cynicism: A Critical Study. Westport, Connecticut: Greenwood Press, 1996.
Paquet, Léonce. Les Cyniques grecs: fragments et témoignages. Ottawa: Presses de l’Universitaire d’Ottawa, 1988.

Author Information

Julie Piering
Email: japiering@ualr.edu
University of Arkansas at Little Rock
U. S. A.

Models

The word “model” is highly ambiguous, and there is no uniform terminology used by either scientists or philosophers. Here, a model is considered to be a representation of some object, behavior, or system that one wants to understand. This article presents the most common type of models found in science as well as the different relations—traditionally called “analogies”—between models and between a given model and its subject. Although once considered merely heuristic devices, they are now seen as indispensable to modern science. There are many different types of models used across the scientific disciplines, although there is no uniform terminology to classify them. The most familiar are physical models such as scale replicas of bridges or airplanes. These, like all models, are used because of their “analogies” to the subjects of the models. A scale model airplane has a structural similarity or “material analogy” to the full scale version. This correspondence allows engineers to infer dynamic properties of the airplane based on wind tunnel experiments on the replica. Physical models also include abstract representations which often include idealizations such as frictionless planes and point masses. Another, but completely different type of model, is constituted by sets of equations. These mathematical models were not always deemed legitimate models by philosophers. Model-to-subject and model-to-model relations are described using several different types of analogies: positive, negative, neutral, material, and formal.

Like unobservable entities, models have been the subject of debate between scientific realists and antirealists. One’s position often depends on what one considers the truth-bearers in science to be. Those who take fundamental laws and/or theories to be true believe that models are true in inverse proportion to the degree of idealization used. Highly idealized models would therefore be (in some sense) less true. Others take models to be true only insofar as they describe the behavior of empirically observable systems. This empiricism leads some to believe that models built from the bottom-up are realistic, while those derived in a top-down manner from abstract laws are not.

Models also play a key role in the semantic view of theories. What counts as a model on this approach, however, is more closely related to the sense of models in mathematical logic than in science itself.

Models in Science
Physical Models
Mathematical Models
State Spaces
Models and Realism
Models and the Semantic View of Theories
References and Further Reading

1. Models in Science

The word “model” is highly ambiguous, and there is no uniform terminology used by either scientists or philosophers. This article presents the most common type of models found in science as well as the different relations—traditionally called “analogies”—between models and between a given model and its subject. For most of the 20th century, the use of models in science was a neglected topic in philosophy. Far more attention was given to the nature of scientific theories and laws. Except for a few philosophers in the 1960’s, Mary Hesse in particular, most did not think the topic was particularly important. The philosophically interesting parts of science were thought to lie elsewhere. As a result, few articles on models were published in twenty-five years following Hesse’s (1966). [These include (Redhead, 1980) and (Wimsatt, 1987), and parts of (Bunge, 1973) and (Cartwright, 1983.] The situation is now quite different. As philosophers of science have come to pay greater attention to actual scientific practice, the use of models has become an import area of philosophical analysis.

2. Physical Models

One familiar type of model is the physical model: a material, pictorial, or analogical representation of (at least some part of) an actual system. “Physical” here is not meant to convey an ontological claim. As we shall see, some physical models are material objects; others are not. Hesse classifies many of these as either replicas or analogue models. Examples of the former are scale models used in wind tunnel experiments. There is what she calls a “material analogy” between the model and its subject, that is, a pretheoretic similarity in how their observable properties are related. Replicas are often used when the laws governing the subject of the model are either unknown or too computationally complex to derive predictions. When a material analogy is present, one assumes that a “formal analogy” also exists between the subject and the model. In a formal analogy, the same laws govern the relevant parts of both the subject and model.

Analogue models, in contrast, have a formal analogy with the subject of the model but no material analogy. In other words, the same laws govern both the subject and the model, although the two are physically quite different. For example, ping-pong balls blowing around in a box (like those used in some state lotteries) constitute an analogue model for an ideal gas. Some analogue models were important before the age of digital computers when simple electric circuits were used as analogues of mechanical systems. Consider a mass M on a frictionless plane that is subject to a time varying force f(t) (Figure 1). This system can be simulated by a circuit with a capacitor C and a time varying voltage source v(t). The voltage across C at time t corresponds to the velocity of M.

Figure 1: Analogue Machine

Today engineers and physicists are more familiar with simplifying models. These are constructed by abstracting away properties and relations that exist in the subject. Here we find the usual zoo of physical idealizations: frictionless planes, perfectly elastic bodies, point masses, and so forth. Consider a textbook mass-spring system with only one degree of freedom (that is, the spring oscillates perfectly along one dimension) shown in Figure 2. This particular system is physically possible, but nonactual. Real springs always wobble just a bit. If by chance a spring did oscillate in one dimension for some time, the event would be unlikely but would not violate any physical laws. Frictionless planes, on the other hand, are nonphysical rather than merely nonactual.

Figure 2: Physical Water Drop Model

Simplifying models provide a context for Hesse’s other relations known as positive, negative, and neutral analogies. Positive analogies are the ways in which the subject and model are alike—the properties and relations they share. Negative analogies occur when there is a mismatch between the two. The idealizations mentioned in the previous paragraph are negatively analogous to their real-world subjects. In a scale-model airplane (a replica), the length of the wing relative to the length of the tail is a positively analogous since the ratio is the same in the subject and the model. The wood used to make the model is negatively analogous since the real airplane would use different materials. Neutral analogies are relations that are in fact either positive or negative, but it is not yet known which. The number of neutral analogies is inversely related to our knowledge of the model and its subject. One uses a physical model with strong, positive analogies in order to probe its neutral analogies for more information. Ideally, all neutral analogies will be sorted into either positive or negative. The early success of the Bohr model of the atom showed that it had positive analogies to real hydrogen atoms. In Hesse’s terms, the neutral analogies proved to be negative when the model was applied to atoms with more than one electron.

The use of “analogy” in this regard has declined somewhat in recent years. “Idealization” has replaced “negative analogy” when these simplifications are built into physical models from the start. The degree to which a model has positive analogies is more typically described by how “realistic” the model is. One might also use the notion of “approximate truth”—a term long recognized as more suggestive than precise. The rough idea is that more realistic models—those with stronger positive analogies—contain more truth than others. “Negative analogy” contains an ambiguity. Some are used at the beginning of the model-building process. The modeler recognizes the false properties for what they are and uses them for a specific purpose—usually to simplify the mathematics. Other negative analogies, known as “artifacts,” are unintended consequences of idealizations, data collection, research methods, and limitations of the medium used to construct the model. Some artifacts are benign and obvious. Consider the wooden models of molecules used in high school chemistry classes. Three balls held together by sticks can represent a water molecule, but the color of the balls is an artifact. (As the early moderns were fond of pointing out, atoms are colorless.) Other artifacts are produced by measuring devices. It is impossible, for example, to fully shield an oscilloscope from the periodic signal produced by its AC current source. This produces a periodic component in the output signal not present in the source itself.

The heavy emphasis here on models in the physical sciences has more to do with the interests of philosophers than scientific practice. Physical models are used throughout the sciences, from immunoglobulin models of allergic reactions to macroeconomic models of the business cycle.

3. Mathematical Models

Philosophers have generally taken physical models as paradigm cases of scientific models. In many branches of science, however, mathematical models play a far more important role. There are many examples, especially in dynamics. Equation (1) below is an ordinary differential equation representing the motion of a frictionless pendulum. [θ is the angle of the string from vertical, l is the length of the string, and g is the acceleration due to gravity. The two dots in the first term stand for the second derivative with respect to time.] Even when sets of equations have clearly been used “to model” some behavior of a system, philosophers were often unwilling to take these as legitimate models. The difference is driven in part by greater familiarity with models in mathematical logic. In the logician’s realm, a model satisfies a set of axioms; the axioms themselves are not models. To philosophers, equations look like axioms. Referring to a set of equations as “a model” then sounds like a category mistake.

(1)

This attitude was eroded in part by the central role mathematical models played in the development of chaos theory. The 1980s saw a deluge of scientific articles with equations governing nonlinear systems as well as the state spaces that represented their evolution over time (see section 4). Physical models, on the other hand, were often bypassed altogether. This made it far more difficult to dismiss “mathematical model” as a scientist’s misnomer. It soon became apparent that all of the issues regarding idealizations, confirmation, and construction of physical models had mathematical counterparts.

Consider the physical model of the electric circuit in Figure 1. A common idealization is to stipulate that the circuit has no resistance. When we look to the associated differential equations—a mathematical model—there is a corresponding simplification, in this case the elimination of an algebraic term that represented the resistance of the wire. Unlike this example, simplification is often more than a mere convenience. The governing equations for many types of phenomena are intractable as they stand. Simplifications are needed to bridge the computational gap between the laws and phenomena they describe. In the old (pre-1926) quantum theory, for example, it was common to run across a Hamiltonian (an important type of function in physics that expresses the total energy of the system) that blocked the usual mathematical techniques—for example, separation of variables. Instead, a perturbation parameter λ was used to convert the problematic Hamiltonian into a power series such as in equation (2) below. [I, θ are classical action-angle variables. See any text on classical mechanics for more on this method.] Once in this form, one may generate an approximate solution for to an arbitrary degree of precision by keeping a finite number of terms and discarding the rest. This is sometimes called a “mediating mathematical model” (Morton 1993) since it operates, in a sense, between the intractable Hamiltonian and the phenomenon it is thought to describe.

(2)

4. State Spaces

State spaces have received scant attention in the philosophical literature until recently. They are often used in tandem with a mathematical model as a means for representing the possible states of a system and its evolution. The “system” is often a physical model, but might also be a real-world phenomenon essentially free of idealizations. Figure 3 is the state space associate with equation (1), the mathematical model for an ideal (frictionless) pendulum. Since θ represents the angle of the string, a,b correspond to the two highest points of deflection. represents velocity. [The coefficient .] Hence c,d are the points at which the pendulum is moving the fastest.

Figure 3: State Space for Ideal Pendulum

State spaces take a variety of forms. Quantum mechanics uses a Hilbert space to represent the state governed by Schrödinger’s equation. The space itself might have an infinite number of dimensions with a vector representing an individual state. The ordinary differential equations used in dynamics require many-dimensional phase spaces. Points represent the system states in these (usually Euclidean) spaces. As the state evolves over time, it carves a trajectory through the space. Every point belongs to some possible trajectory that represents the system’s actual or possible evolution. A phase space together with a set of trajectories forms a phase portrait (Figure 4). Since the full phase portrait cannot be captured in a diagram, only a handful of possible trajectories are shown in textbook illustrations. If the system allows for dissipation (for example friction), attractors can develop in the associated phase portrait. As the name implies, an attractor is a set of points toward which neighboring trajectories flow, though the points themselves possess no actual attractive force. The center of Figure 4a, known as a point attractor, might represent a marble coming to rest at the bottom of a bowl. Simple periodic motion, like a clock pendulum, produces limit cycles, attracting sets forming closed curves in phase space (Figure 4b).

Figure 4: Sample Phase Portraits

Let us consider a very simple system—a leaky faucet—that illustrates the use of each type of model mentioned. Researchers at the University of California, Santa Cruz, believed that the time between drops does not change randomly over time, but instead has an underlying dynamical structure (Martien 1985). In other words, one drip interval causally influences the next. In order to explore this hypothesis, a simplified physical model for a drop of water was developed (the one shown above in Figure 2). They believed that a water drop is roughly like a one-dimensional, oscillating mass on a spring. Part of the mass detaches when the spring extends to a critical point. The amount of mass that detaches depends on the velocity of the block when it reaches this point.

The mathematical model (3) for this system is relatively simple. y is the vertical position of the drop, v is its velocity, m is its mass prior to detachment, and Δm is the amount of mass that detaches (k, b, and c are constants). When this model is simulated on a computer, the resulting phase portrait is very similar to the one that was reconstructed from the data in the lab. Although this qualitative agreement is too weak to completely vindicate these models of the dripping faucet, it does provide a small degree confirmation.

(3)

Going back to the physical model, there are two clear idealizations/negative analogies. First, of course, is that water drops are not shaped like rigid blocks. Second, the mass-spring model only oscillates along one axis. Real liquids are not constrained in this way. However, these idealization allow for a far simpler mathematical model to be used than one would need for a realistic fluid. (Without these idealizations, (3) would have to be replaced by a difficult partial differential equation.) In addition, Peter Smith has argued that this mathematical tractability came with a steep price, namely, an unrecognized artifact (1998). The problem is that the state space for this particular system contains a “strange attractor” with a fractal structure, a geometrical structure far more complex than the attractors in Figure 4. Smith argues that the infinitely intricate structure of this attractor is an artifact of the mathematics used to describe the evolution of the system. If more realistic physical and mathematical models were used, this negative analogy would likewise disappear.

5. Models and Realism

One of the perennial debates in the philosophy of science has to do with realism. What aspects of science—if any—truly represent the real world? Which devices, on the other hand, are merely heuristic? Antirealists hold that some parts of the scientific enterprise—laws, unobservable entities, and so forth—do not correspond to anything in reality. (Some, like van Fraassen (1980), would say that if by chance the abstract terms used by scientists did denote something real, we have no way of knowing it.) Scientific realists argue that the successful use of these devices shows that they are, at least in part, truly describing the real world. Let’s now consider what role models have played in this debate.

Whether models should be taken realistically depends on what one takes the truth-bearers in science to be. Some hold that foundational, scientific truths are contained either in mature theories or their fundamental laws. If so, then idealized models are simply false. The argument for this is straightforward (Achinstein 1965). Let’s say that theory T describes a system S in terms of properties p1, p2, and p3. As we have seen, simplified models either modify or ignore some of the properties found in more fundamental theories. Say that a physical model M describes S in terms of p1 and p4. If so, then T describes S in one way; M describes S in a logically incompatible way. The simplifying assumptions needed to build a useful model contradict the claims of the governing theory. Hence, if T is true, M is false.

In contrast, Nancy Cartwright has long argued that abstract laws, no matter how “fundamental” to our understanding of nature, are not literally true. In her earlier work (1983), she argued that it is not models that are highly idealized, but rather the laws themselves. Abstract laws are useful for organizing scientific knowledge, but are not literally true when applied to concrete systems. They are “true,” she argues, only insofar as they correctly describe simplified physical models (or “simulacra”). Fundamental laws are true-of-the-model, not true simpliciter. The idea is something like being true-in-a-novel. The claim “The beast that terrorized the island of Amity in 1975 was a squid” is false-in-the-novel Jaws. Similarly, Newton’s second law of motion plus universal gravitation are only true-in-Newtonian-particle-models.

For most scientific realists, whether physical models are “true” or “real” is not a simple yes-or-no question. Most would point out that even idealizations like the frictionless plane are not simply false. For two blocks of iron sliding past each other, neglecting friction is a poor approximation. For skis sliding over an icy slope, it is much better. In other words, negative analogies come in degrees. If the idealizations are negligible, we may properly say that a physical model is realistic.

Scientific realists have not always held similar views about mathematical models. Textbook model building in the physical sciences often follows a “top-down” approach: start with general laws and first principles and then work toward the specifics of the phenomenon of interest. Dynamics texts are filled with models that can serve as the foundation for a more detailed mathematical treatment (for example, an ideal damped pendulum or a point particle moving in a central field). Philosophers have paid much less attention to models constructed from the bottom-up, that is, models that begin with the data rather than theory. What little attention bottom-up modeling did receive in the older modeling literature was almost entirely negative. Conventional wisdom seemed to be that phenomenological laws and curve-fitting methods were devices researchers sometimes had to stoop to in order to get a project off the ground. They were not considered models, but rather “mathematical hypotheses designed to fit experimental data” (Hesse 1967, 38). According to Ernan McMullin, sometimes physicists—and other scientists presumably—simply want a function that summarizes their observations (1967, 390-391). Curve-fitting and phenomenological laws do just that. The question of realism is avoided by denying the legitimacy of bottom-up mathematical models.

In her broad attack on “theory-driven” philosophy of science, Cartwright has recently defended a nearly opposite view (1999). She argues that top-down mathematical models are not realistic, but bottom-up models are. Once again, this verdict follows from a more general thesis about the truth-bearers in science. Cartwright is an antirealist about fundamental laws and abstract theories which, she claims, serve only to systematize scientific knowledge. Since top-down mathematical models use these laws as first principles from which to begin, they cannot possibly represent real systems. Bottom-up models, on the other hand, are not derived from covering laws. They are instead tied to experimental knowledge of particular systems. Unlike fundamental theories and their associated top-down models, bottom-up models are designed to represent actual objects and their behavior. It is this grounding in empirical knowledge that allows these kinds of mathematical models to be the primary device in science for representing real-world systems.

6. Models and the Semantic View of Theories

This typology of models and their properties has been developed with an eye toward scientific practice. Within the philosophy of science itself, models have also played a central role in understanding the nature of scientific theories. For most of the 20th century, philosophers considered theories to be special sets of sentences. Theories on this so-called “syntactic view” are linguistic entities. The meaning of the theory is contained in the sentences that constitute it, roughly the same way the meaning of this article is contained in these sentences. The semantic view, in contrast, uses the model-theoretic language of mathematical logic. In broad terms, a theory just is a family of models. The theory/model distinction collapses. Using the terminology we have already defined, a model in this sense might be an idealized physical model, an existing system in nature, or even a state space. The semantic content of a theory, on this view, is found in a family of models rather than in the sentences that describe them. If a given theory were axiomatized—a rare occurrence—one could think of these models as those entities for which the axioms are true. To take a toy example, say T1 is a theory whose sole axiom is “for any two lines, at most one point lies on both.” Figure 5 is one model that constitutes T1:

Figure 5: A Model of Theory T1

A model for ideal gases would be a physical model of dilute, perfectly elastic atoms in a closed container with an ordered set of parameters P, V, m, M, T> that satisfies the equation . (Respectively, pressure, volume, mass of the gases, molecular weight of the molecules, and temperature. R is a constant). In fact two different sets of parameters P1, V1, m1, M1, T1> and P2, V2, m1, M1, T2> constitute two separate models in the same family.

Some advocates of the semantic view claim that the use of the term “model” is similar in science and in logic (van Fraassen, 1980). This similarity has been one of the motivating forces behind this particular understanding of scientific theories. Given the distinctions made in previous sections of this article, this similarity seems to be questionable.

First, many things that would count as a model on the semantic view, for example the geometric diagram in Figure 5, are not physical models, mathematical models, or state spaces. In what sense, one wonders, are they scientific models? Moreover, a model on the semantic view might be an existing physical system. For example, Jupiter and its moons would constitute another model of Newton’s laws of motion plus universal gravitation. This blurs the distinction between the model and its subject. One may use a physical and/or mathematical model to study celestial bodies, but such entities are not themselves models. The scientist’s use of the term is not this broad.

Second, as we have already seen, sets of equations often constitute mathematical models. In contrast, laws and equations on the semantic approach are said to describe and classify models, but are never themselves taken to be models. Their relation is satisfaction, not identity.

Some time before the semantic view became popular, Hesse issued what still seems to be the correct verdict: “[M]ost uses of ‘model’ in science do carry over from logic the idea of interpretation of a deductive system,” however, “most writers on models in the sciences agree that there is little else in common between the scientist’s and the logician’s use of the term, either in the nature of the entities referred to or in the purpose for which they are used” (1967, 354).

7. References and Further Reading

Achinstein, P. “Theoretical Models.” The British Journal for the Philosophy of Science 16 (1965): 102-120.
Bunge, M. Method, Model and Matter. Dordrecht: Reidel, 1973.
Cartwright, N. How the Laws of Physics Lie. New York: Clarendon Press, 1983.
Cartwright, N. The Dappled World. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1999.
Hesse, M. Models and Analogies in Science. Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press, 1966.
Hesse, M. “Models and Analogy in Science.” The Encyclopedia of Philosophy. New York: Macmillan Publishing, 1967.
McMullin, E. “What do Physical Models Tell Us?” Logic, Methodology, and Philosophy of Science III. Eds. B. van Rootselaar and J. F. Staal. Amsterdam: North-Holland Publishing, 1967: 385-396.
Morrison, M. and M. Morgan, eds. Models as Mediators. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1999.
Morton, A. “Mathematical Models: Questions of Trustworthiness.” The British Journal for the Philosophy of Science 44 (1993): 659-674.
Morton, A. and M. Suàrez. “Kinds of Models.” Model Validation in Hydrological Science. Eds. P. Bates and M. Anderson. New York: John Wiley Press, 2001.
Redhead, M. “Models in Physics.” The British Journal for the Philosophy of Science 31 (1980): 154-163.
Smith, P. Explaining Chaos. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1998.
Van Fraassen, B. The Scientific Image. New York: Clarendon Press, 1980.
Wimsatt, W. “False Models as Means to Truer Theories.” Neutral Models in Biology. Eds. M. Nitecki and A. Hoffmann. New York: Oxford University Press, 1987.

Author Information

Jeffrey Koperski
Email: koperski@svsu.edu
Saginaw Valley State University
U. S. A.

Cynics

Cynicism originates in the philosophical schools of ancient Greece that claim a Socratic lineage. To call the Cynics a “school” though, immediately raises a difficulty for so unconventional and anti-theoretical a group. Their primary interests are ethical, but they conceive of ethics more as a way of living than as a doctrine in need of explication. As such askēsis—a Greek word meaning a kind of training of the self or practice—is fundamental. The Cynics, as well as the Stoics who followed them, characterize the Cynic way of life as a “shortcut to virtue” (see Diogenes Laertius, Lives of Eminent Philosophers, Book 6, Chapter 104 and Book 7, Chapter 122). Though they often suggest that they have discovered the quickest, and perhaps surest, path to the virtuous life, they recognize the difficulty of this route.

The colorfulness of the Cynic way of life presents certain problems. The triumph of the Cynic as a philosophical and literary character complicates discussions of the historical individuals, a complication further troubled by a lack of sources. The evidence regarding the Cynics is limited to apothegms, aphorisms, and ancient hearsay; none of the many Cynic texts have survived. The tradition records the tenets of Cynicism via their lives. It is through their practices, the selves and lives that they cultivated, that we come to know the particular Cynic ēthos.

History of the Name
Major Figures and the Cynic Lineage
Cynic Ethics
1. Living in Accord with Nature and Opposing Conventions
  1. Freedom and Parrhēsia
  2. Training and Toughness
Cosmopolitanism
The Cynic Legacy
References and Further Reading

1. History of the Name

The origin of the Cynic name kunikos, a Greek word meaning “dog-like”, is a point of contention. Two competing stories explain the source of the name using the figure of Antisthenes (whom Diogenes Laertius identifies controversially as the original Cynic), and yet a third explanation uses the figure of Diogenes of Sinope. First, Antisthenes is said to have taught in the Cynosarges, which is a Greek word that might mean “White Dog,” “Quick Dog,” or even “Dog’s Meat”. The Cynosarges is a gymnasium and temple for Athenian nothoi. “Nothoi” is a term that designates one who is without Athenian citizenship because of being born to a slave, foreigner, or prostitute; one can also be nothoi if one’s parents were citizens but not legally married. According to the first explanation, the term Cynic would, then, derive from the place in which the movement’s founder worshipped, exercised, and, most importantly, lectured. Such a derivation is suspect insofar as later writers could have created the story through an analogy to the way in which the term “Stoic” came from the Stoa Poikilē in which Zeno of Citium taught. Though nothing unquestionably links Antisthenes or any other Cynic to the Cynosarges, Antisthenes was a nothos and the temple was used for worshipping Hercules, the ultimate Cynic hero.

A second possible derivation comes from Antisthenes’ alleged nickname Haplokuōn, a word that probably means a dog “pure and simple”, and is presumably referring to his way of living. Though Antisthenes was known for a certain rudeness and crudeness that could have led to such a name, and later authors, including Aelian, Epictetus, and Stobaeus, identify him as a kuōn, or dog, his contemporaries, such as Plato and Xenophon, do not label him as such. This lack lends some credence to the notion that the term kunikos was applied to Antisthenes posthumously, and only after Diogenes of Sinope, a more illustrious philosopher-dog, had arrived on the scene.

If Antisthenes was not the first Cynic by name, then the origin of the appellation falls to Diogenes of Sinope, an individual well known for dog-like behavior. As such, the term may have begun as an insult referring to Diogenes’ style of life, especially his proclivity to perform all of his activities in public. Shamelessness, which allowed Diogenes to use any space for any purpose, was primary in the invention of “Diogenes the Dog.”

The precise source of the term “Cynic” is, however, less important than the wholehearted appropriation of it. The first Cynics, beginning most clearly with Diogenes of Sinope, embraced their title: they barked at those who displeased them, spurned Athenian etiquette, and lived from nature. In other words, what may have originated as a disparaging label became the designation of a philosophical vocation.

Finally, because Cynicism denotes a way of living, it is inaccurate to equate Cynicism with the other schools of its day. The Cynics had no set space where they met and discoursed, such as the Garden, the Lyceum, or the Academy; for Diogenes and Crates, the streets of Athens provide the setting for both their teaching and their training. Moreover, the Cynics neglect, and very often ridicule, speculative philosophy. They are especially harsh critics of dogmatic thought, theories they consider useless, and metaphysical essences.

2. Major Figures and the Cynic Lineage

The major figures within Cynicism form the pivotal points within a lineage traced from Antisthenes, Socrates’ companion and a major interlocutor in the Socratic dialogues of Xenophon (see especially his Memorabilia and Symposium), through his student, Diogenes of Sinope, to Diogenes’ pupil Crates, and from Crates to both Hipparchia of Maronea, the first known woman Cynic philosopher, and Zeno of Citium, the founder of Stoicism.

Some others among the more notable Cynics include Metrocles of Maronea, brother to Hipparchia and pupil of Crates, Menippus, Demonax of Cyprus, Bion of Borysthenes, and Teles. Thinkers heavily influenced by Cynic thought include Zeno of Citium, Cleanthes of Assos, Aristo of Chios, Musonius Rufus, Epictetus, Dio Chrysostom, and the emperor Julian.

The Socratic schools tend to trace their lineage directly back to Socrates and the Cynics are no exception. As such, the historical authenticity of this heredity is suspect. Nevertheless, it accurately tracks a kind of intellectual transmission that begins with Antisthenes and is passed on to Diogenes, Crates, and Zeno. Cynics seem to have survived into the third century CE; two of Julian’s orations from 361 CE disparage the Cynics of his day for lacking the asceticism and hardiness of “real” Cynics. As a “school” of thought, Cynicism ends in the sixth century CE, but its legacy continues in both philosophy and literature.

3. Cynic Ethics

Foremost for understanding the Cynic conception of ethics is that virtue is a life lived in accord with nature. Nature offers the clearest indication of how to live the good life, which is characterized by reason, self-sufficiency, and freedom. Social conventions, however, can hinder the good life by compromising freedom and setting up a code of conduct that is opposed to nature and reason. Conventions are not inherently bad; however, for the Cynic, conventions are often absurd and worthy of ridicule. The Cynics deride the attention paid to the Olympics, the “big thieves” who run the temples and are seen carrying away the “little thieves” who steal from them, politicians as well as the philosophers who attend their courts, fashion, and prayers for such things as fame and fortune.

Only once one has freed oneself from the strictures that impede an ethical life can one be said to be truly free. As such, the Cynics advocate askēsis, or practice, over theory as the means to free oneself from convention, promote self-sufficiency, and live in accord with nature. Such askēsis leads the Cynic to live in poverty, embrace hardship and toil, and permits the Cynic to speak freely about the silly, and often vicious, way life is lived by his or her contemporaries. The Cynics consistently undermine the most hallowed principles of Athenian culture, but they do so for the sake of replacing them with those in accord with reason, nature, and virtue.

a. Living in Accord with Nature and Opposing Conventions

Though the imperative to live life in accord with nature is rightly associated with Stoicism, the Stoics are following a Cynic lead. Diogenes of Sinope fervently rejects nomos, or convention, by showing the arbitrary and frequently amusing nature of Athenian social, religious, and political mores and trampling the authority of religious and political leaders. Fundamental to this is a redefinition of what is worthy of shame. Diogenes’ body is disorderly, a source of great shame among the Athenians and the reservoir for the principle of shamelessness among the Cynics.

Diogenes uses his body to upend the conventional association of decorum with the good. He breaks etiquette by publicly carrying out activities an Athenian would typically perform in private. For example, he eats, drinks, and masturbates in the marketplace, and ridicules the shame felt when one’s body is unruly or clumsy. This does not mean, however, that there is nothing about which a person ought to feel shame. For example, in Lives of Emminent Philosophers, one finds the following anecdote: “Observing a fool tuning a harp, ‘Are you not ashamed,’ he said, ‘to give this wood concordant sounds, while you fail to harmonize your soul with your life?’ To one who protested ‘I am unfit to study philosophy,’ Diogenes said, ‘Why then live, if you do not care to live well?’” (Diogenes Laertius, Book 6, Chapter 65; R.D. Hicks’ translation is altered for this article.)

As Diogenes ’ reappraisal of shame suggests, the Cynics are not relativists. Nature replaces convention as the standard for judgment. The Cynics believe that it is through nature that one can live well and not through conventional means such as etiquette or religion. One reads that Diogenes of Sinope “would rebuke men in general with regard to their prayers, declaring that they asked for things which seemed to them to be good, not for such as are truly good” (Diogenes Laertius, Lives of Eminent Philosophers, Book 6, Chapter 43). This captures the crux of the Cynic notion of living in accord with nature and contrary to convention. Praying for wealth, fame, or any of the other trappings convention leads one to believe are good is a mistaken enterprise. Life, as given by nature, is full of hints as to how to live it best; but humans go astray, ashamed by petty things and striving after objects, which are unimportant. Consequently, their freedom is hindered by convention.

i. Freedom and Parrhēsia

The Cynics clearly privilege freedom, but not merely in a personal sense as a kind of negative liberty. Instead, freedom is advocated in three related forms: eleutheria, freedom or liberty, autarkeia, self-sufficiency, and parrhēsia, freedom of speech or frankness. Their conception of freedom has some shared aspects with other ancient schools; the notion of autonomy which derives from the imperative that reason rule over the passions is found in the ethics of multiple Classical and Hellenistic thinkers. A specifically Cynic sense of freedom, though, is evident in parrhēsia.

An element of parrhēsia, which can be overlooked when it is defined as free or frank speech, is the risk that accompanies speaking so freely and frankly. Legendary examples of the Cynic’s fearlessly free speech occur in Diogenes of Sinope’s interchanges with Alexander the Great. One such example is the following: “When he was sunning himself in the Craneum, Alexander came and stood over him and said, ‘Ask of me any boon you like.’ To which he replied, ‘Stand out of my light’” (Diogenes Laertius, Lives of Eminent Philosophers, Book 6, Chapter 28). At another point, Alexander pronounces his rank to Diogenes of Sinope by saying, “I am Alexander the Great King.” Diogenes responds with his own rank, “I am Diogenes the Cynic,” which is to say “Diogenes the Dog” (Diogenes Laertius, Lives of Eminent Philosophers, Book 6, Chapter 60).

The examples above demonstrate the unique confluence of humor, fearless truth telling, and political subversion which distinguishes the Cynic way of living. With a few notable exceptions, the philosophers of antiquity can be found at some time or another in the company of rulers (Plato, Aeschines, and Aristippus all attended the court of Dionysius, Xenophon is intimately associated with Cyrus, Aristotle with the Macedonian ruling family, and so on). The Cynics, however, made it a point to shun such contact. The Cynics strive for self-sufficiency and strength, neither of which is capable of being maintained once one enters into the conventional political game. The life of an impoverished, but virtuous and self-sufficient philosopher is preferable to the life of a pampered court philosopher.

Diogenes Laertius writes that, “Plato saw [Diogenes of Sinope] washing lettuces, came up to him and quietly said to him, ‘Had you paid court to Dionysius, you wouldn’t now be washing lettuces,’ and [Diogenes] with equal calmness answered, ‘If you had washed lettuces, you wouldn’t have paid court to Dionysius’” (Lives of Eminent Philosophers, Book 6, Chapter 58). The lesson of this exchange is clear: whereas Plato views paying court as freeing one from poverty, the Cynic sees poverty as freeing one from having to pay court to a ruler. This second sense of freedom so forcefully advocated by the Cynics, comprises both autarkeia, or self-sufficiency, and parrhēsia, or the freedom to speak the truth: something one at court is never free to do. It is no surprise, then, that when asked what is “the most beautiful thing in the world,” Diogenes replied, “Parrhēsia.” (Diogenes Laertius, Lives of Eminent Philosophers, Book 6, Chapter 69.)

ii. Training and Toughness

In order to live the Cynic life, one had to be inured to the various physical hardships entailed by such freedom. This required, then, a life of constant training, or askēsis. The term askēsis, defined above as a kind of training of the self but which also means “exercise” or “practice,” is appropriated from athletic training. Instead of training the body for the sake of victory in the Olympic Games, on the battlefield, or for general good health, the Cynic trains the body for the sake of the soul.

The examples of Cynic training are multiple: Antisthenes praised toil and hardship as goods; Diogenes of Sinope walked barefoot in the snow, hugged cold statues, and rolled about in the scalding summer sand in his pithos; Crates rid himself of his considerable wealth in order to become a Cynic. The ability to live without any of the commodities usually mistaken for necessities is liberating and beneficial. It is also, however, a difficult lesson: “[Diogenes of Sinope] used to say that he followed the example of the trainers of choruses; for they too set the note a little high, to ensure that the rest should hit the right note” (Diogenes Laertius, Book 6, Chapter 35).

4. Cosmopolitanism

The Cynics are not always given credit when it comes to the notion of cosmopolitanism, for the origin of this term is at times ascribed to Stoicism. Moreover, when it is attributed to Cynicism, it is often characterized as a negative tenet that gains content only once it is transplanted into Stoic doctrine (see John L. Moles’ discussion of “Cynic Cosmopolitanism” in The Cynics). However, cosmopolitanism can be fully understood within its Cynic context if it is taken as more than an oxymoron or a pithy retort: “Asked where he came from, [Diogenes of Sinope] said, ‘I am a citizen of the world [kosmopolitēs]’” (Diogenes Laertius, Book 6, Chapter 63). In this last quote, Diogenes is responding to a question calling for him to state his origin with what seems to be a neologism. To be a politēs is to belong to a polis, to be a member of a specific society with all of the benefits and commitments such membership entails. By not responding with the expected “Sinope,” Diogenes is renouncing his duty to Sinopeans as well as his right to be aided by them. It is important to note that Diogenes does not say that he is apolis, that is, without a polis; he claims allegiance to the kosmos, or the universe.

The Cynics, then, cast the notion of citizenship in a new light. To the Greek male of the Classical and Hellenistic period, citizenship was of utmost value. The restrictions on citizenship made it a privilege and these exclusions are, to the Cynic, absurd. Under cosmopolitanism, the Cynic challenges the civic affiliation of the few by opening the privilege to all. General national affiliation was likewise esteemed, and Diogenes’ cosmopolitan response is therefore also a rejection of the limitations of such a view.

Finally, cosmopolitanism revises the traditional conception of the political duties of an individual. As such, the Cynic is freed to live according to nature and not according to the laws and conventions of the polis. The conventional polis is not just rejected but replaced. This has important ethical connections to the notion of living in accord with nature, and can likewise be seen as an important precursor to the Stoic understanding of physis, or nature, as identical to the kosmos, or universe.

5. The Cynic Legacy

The first and most direct Cynic influence is upon the founding of Stoicism. One story, preserved in Diogenes Laertius, tells of Zeno of Citium reading a copy of Xenophon’s Memorabilia in a bookshop while shipwrecked in Athens. He became so taken with the figure of Socrates that he asked the bookseller where he might find such a man. At just that moment, Crates passed by, and the bookseller pointed him out as the one to follow.

Though this, like many of Diogenes Laertius’ stories, may strike one as too propitious to be historically accurate, it preserves the way in which the primary tenets of Stoicism emerge out of Cynicism. The primacy of ethics, the sufficiency of virtue for happiness, the cultivation of indifference to external affairs, the definition of virtue as living in accord with nature, and the importance placed on askēsis, all mark the shared terrain between the Cynics and the Stoics. Indeed, when various Stoic thinkers list the handful of Stoic sages, Cynics, and especially Diogenes of Sinope, are typically among them. Epictetus in particular advocates the Cynic stance, but warns against taking up lightly something so difficult (see Discourses 3.22).

Within political philosophy, the Cynics can be seen as originators of anarchism. Since humans are both rational and able to be guided by nature, it follows that humans have little need for legal codes or political affiliations. Indeed, political associations at times require one to be vicious for the sake of the polis. Diogenes’ cosmopolitanism represents, then, a first suggestion that human affiliation ought to be to humanity rather than a single state.

The impact of Cynicism is also felt in Christian, Medieval, and Renaissance thought, though not without a good deal of ambivalence. Christian authors, for example, praise the Cynics for their self-discipline, independence, and mendicant lifestyle, but rebuke the bawdy aspects of Cynic shamelessness.

Finally, the mark of the Cynic is found throughout the texts of literature and philosophy. Menippean Satire has a clear debt, and Diogenes of Sinope in particular appears as a character in literary and philosophical contexts; Dante, for example, situates Diogenes with other virtuous but pagan philosophers in the first level of hell and Nietzsche is especially fond of both Diogenes and the Cynic attitude. One striking example occurs in section 125 of The Gay Science. Here Nietzsche alludes to the anecdote wherein Diogenes searches for a human being with a lit lamp in daylight (D.L. 6.41). In his own rendition, Nietzsche tells the story of the madman who entered the marketplace with a lit lamp on a bright morning seeking God. It is this same madman who pronounces that God is dead.

6. References and Further Reading

Billerbeck, Margarethe. Die Kyniker in der modernen Forschung. Amsterdam: B.R. Grüner, 1991.
Branham, Bracht and Marie-Odile Goulet-Cazé, eds. The Cynics: The Cynic Movement in Antiquity and Its Legacy. Berkeley: University of California Press, 1996.
Dudley, D. R. A History of Cynicism from Diogenes to the 6th Century A.D. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1937.
Epictetus. The Discourses as Reported by Arrian. Trans. W.A. Oldfather. Cambridge: Harvard University Press, 1928.
Goulet-Cazé, Marie-Odile. L’Ascèse cynique: Un commentaire de Diogène Laërce VI 70-71, Deuxième édition. Paris: Libraire Philosophique J. VRIN, 2001.
Goulet-Cazé, Marie-Odile and Richard Goulet, eds.Le Cynisme ancien et ses prolongements. Paris: Presses Universitaires de France, 1993.
Hock, R.F. “Simon the Shoemaker as an Ideal Cynic,” in Greek, Roman and Byzantine Studies, 17 (1976).
Diogenes Laertius. Lives of Eminent Philosophers Vol. I-II. Trans. R.D. Hicks. Cambridge: Harvard University Press, 1979.
Long, A.A. and David N. Sedley, eds. The Hellenistic Philosophers, Volume 1 andVolume 2. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1987.
Malherbe, Abraham J., ed. and trans. The Cynic Epistles. Missoula, Montana: Scholars Press, 1977.
Navia, Luis E. Diogenes of Sinope: The Man in the Tub. Westport, Connecticut: Greenwood Press, 1990.
Navia, Luis E. Classical Cynicism: A Critical Study. Westport, Connecticut: Greenwood Press, 1996.
Navia, Luis E. Antisthenes of Athens. Westport, Connecticut: Greenwood Press, 2001.
Paquet, Léonce. Les Cyniques grecs: fragments et témoignages. Ottawa: Presses de l’Universitaire d’Ottawa, 1988.
Sloterdijk, Peter. Critique of Cynical Reason. Trans. Michael Eldred. Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press, 1987

Author Information

Julie Piering
Email: japiering@ualr.edu
University of Arkansas at Little Rock
U. S. A.

Free Will

Most of us are certain that we have free will, though what exactly this amounts to is much less certain. According to David Hume, the question of the nature of free will is “the most contentious question of metaphysics.” If this is correct, then figuring out what free will is will be no small task indeed. Minimally, to say that an agent has free will is to say that the agent has the capacity to choose his or her course of action. But animals seem to satisfy this criterion, and we typically think that only persons, and not animals, have free will. Let us then understand free will as the capacity unique to persons that allows them to control their actions. It is controversial whether this minimal understanding of what it means to have a free will actually requires an agent to have a specific faculty of will, whether the term “free will” is simply shorthand for other features of persons, and whether there really is such a thing as free will at all.

This article considers why we should care about free will and how freedom of will relates to freedom of action. It canvasses a number of the dominant accounts of what the will is, and then explores the persistent question of the relationship between free will and causal determinism, articulating a number of different positions one might take on the issue. For example, does determinism imply that there is no free will, as the incompatibilists argue, or does it allow for free will, as the compatibilists argue? This article explores several influential arguments that have been given in favor of these two dominant positions on the relationship between free will and causal determinism. Finally, there is a brief examination of how free will relates to theological determinism and logical determinism.

Free Will, Free Action and Moral Responsibility
Accounts of the Will
Free Will and Determinism
Arguments for Incompatibilism (or Arguments against Compatibilism)
Arguments for Compatibilism (or Arguments against Incompatibilism)
Related Issues
1. Theological Determinism
2. Logical Determinism
References and Further Reading

1. Free Will, Free Action and Moral Responsibility

Why should we even care whether or not agents have free will? Probably the best reason for caring is that free will is closely related to two other important philosophical issues: freedom of action and moral responsibility. However, despite the close connection between these concepts, it is important not to conflate them.

We most often think that an agent’s free actions are those actions that she does as a result of exercising her free will. Consider a woman, Allison, who is contemplating a paradigmatic free action, such as whether or not to walk her dog. Allison might say to herself, “I know I should walk the dog—he needs the exercise. And while I don’t really want to walk him since it is cold outside, I think overall the best decision to make is that I should take him for a walk.” Thus, we see that one reason we care about free will is that it seems necessary for free action—Allison must first decide, or choose, to walk the dog before she actually takes him outside for his walk. If we assume that human actions are those actions that result from the rational capacities of humans, we then see that the possibility of free action depends on the possibility of free will: to say that an agent acted freely is minimally to say that the agent was successful in carrying out a free volition or choice.

Various philosophers have offered just such an account of freedom. Thomas Hobbes suggested that freedom consists in there being no external impediments to an agent doing what he wants to do: “A free agent is he that can do as he will, and forbear as he will, and that liberty is the absence of external impediments.” In An Enquiry Concerning Human Understanding, David Hume thought that free will (or “liberty,” to use his term) is simply the “power of acting or of not acting, according to the determination of the will: that is, if we choose to remain at rest, we may; if we choose to move, we also may.… This hypothetical liberty is universally allowed to belong to everyone who is not a prisoner and in chains.” This suggests that freedom is simply the ability to select a course of action, and an agent is free if he is not being prevented by some external obstacle from completing that course of action. Thus, Hobbes and Hume would hold that Allison is free to walk her dog so long as nothing prevents her from carrying out her decision to walk her dog, and she is free not to walk her dog so long as nothing would compel her to walk her dog if she would decide not to.

However, one might still believe this approach fails to make an important distinction between these two related, but conceptually distinct, kinds of freedom: freedom of will versus freedom of action. This distinction is motivated by the apparent fact that agents can possess free will without also having freedom of action. Suppose that before Allison made the choice to walk the dog, she was taking a nap. And while Allison slept, there was a blizzard that moved through the area. The wind has drifted the snow up against the front of her house so that it is impossible for Allison to get out her front door and walk her dog even if she wanted to. So here we have a case involving free will, because Allison has chosen to take the dog for a walk, but not involving free action, because Allison is not able to take her dog for a walk.

Whether or not one can have freedom of action without free will depends on one’s view of what free will is. Also, the truth of causal determinism would not entail that agents lack the freedom to do what they want to do. An agent could do what she wants to do, even if she is causally determined to do that action. Thus, both Hobbes and Hume are rightly characterized as compatibilists.

Even if there is a distinction between freedom of will and freedom of action, it appears that free will is necessary for the performance of free actions. If Allison is brainwashed during her nap to want to walk her dog, then even if no external impediment prevents her from carrying through with this decision, we would say that her taking the dog for a walk is not a free action. Presumably, the reason why it would not be a free action is because, in the case of brainwashing, Allison’s decision does not arise from her free will. Thus, it looks like free will might be a necessary condition for free action, even if the two are distinct. In what follows, the phrase “acting with free will” means engaging in an action as the result of the utilization of free will. Use of the phrase does not deny the distinction between free will and free action.

The second reason to care about free will is that it seems to be required for moral responsibility. While there are various accounts of what exactly moral responsibility is, it is widely agreed that moral responsibility is distinct from causal responsibility. Consider a falling branch that lands on a car, breaking its window. While the branch is causally responsible for the broken window, it is not morally responsible for it because branches are not moral agents. Depending on one’s account of causation, it also might be possible to be morally responsible for an event or state of affairs even if one is not causally responsible for that same event or state of affairs. For present purposes, let us simply say that an agent is morally responsible for an event or state of affairs only if she is the appropriate recipient of moral praise or moral blame for that event or state of affairs (an agent can thus be morally responsible even if no one, including herself, actually does blame or praise her for her actions). According to the dominant view of the relationship between free will and moral responsibility, if an agent does not have free will, then that agent is not morally responsible for her actions. For example, if Allison is coerced into doing a morally bad act, such as stealing a car, we shouldn’t hold her morally responsible for this action since it is not an action that she did of her own free will.

Some philosophers do not believe that free will is required for moral responsibility. According to John Martin Fischer, human agents do not have free will, but they are still morally responsible for their choices and actions. In a nutshell, Fischer thinks that the kind of control needed for moral responsibility is weaker than the kind of control needed for free will. Furthermore, he thinks that the truth of causal determinism would preclude the kind of control needed for free will, but that it wouldn’t preclude the kind of control needed for moral responsibility. See Fischer (1994). As this example shows, virtually every issue pertaining to free will is contested by various philosophers.

However, many think that the significance of free will is not limited to its necessity for free action and moral responsibility. Various philosophers suggest that free will is also a requirement for agency, rationality, the autonomy and dignity of persons, creativity, cooperation, and the value of friendship and love [see Anglin (1990), Kane (1998) and Ekstrom (1999)]. We thus see that free will is central to many philosophical issues.

2. Accounts of the Will

Nearly every major figure in the history of philosophy has had something or other to say about free will. The present section considers three of the most prominent theories of what the will is.

a. Faculties Model of the Will

The faculties model of the will has its origin in the writings of ancient philosophers such as Plato and Aristotle, and it was the dominant view of the will for much of medieval and modern philosophy [see Descartes (1998) and the discussion of Aquinas in Stump (2003)]. It still has numerous proponents in the contemporary literature. What is distinct about free agents, according to this model, is their possession of certain powers or capacities. All living things possess some capacities, such as the capacities for growth and reproduction. What is unique about free agents, however, is that they also possess the capacities for intellection and volition. Another way of saying this is that free agents alone have the faculties of intellect and will. It is in virtue of having these additional faculties, and the interaction between them, that agents have free will.

The intellect, or the rational faculty, is the power of cognition. As a result of its cognitions, the intellect presents various things to the will as good under some description. To return to the case of Allison contemplating walking her dog, Allison’s intellect might evaluate walking the dog as good for the health of the dog. Furthermore, all agents that have an intellect also have a will. The will, or the volitional faculty, is an appetite for the good; that is, it is naturally drawn to goodness. The will, therefore, cannot pursue an option that the intellect presents as good in no way. The will is also able to command the other faculties; the will can command the body to move or the intellect to consider something. In the case of Allison, the will could command the body to pick up the leash, attach it to the dog, and go outside for a walk. As Aquinas, a proponent of this view of the will, puts it: “Only an agent endowed with an intellect can act with a judgment which is free, in so far as it apprehends the common note of goodness; from which it can judge this or the other thing to be good. Consequently, wherever there is intellect, there is free will” (Summa Theologiae, q. 59 a. 3). Thus, through the interaction between the intellect and will, an agent has free will to pursue something that it perceives as good.

b. Hierarchical Model of the Will

A widely influential contemporary account of the will is Harry Frankfurt’s hierarchical view of the will [see Frankfurt (1971)]. This account is also sometimes called a “structuralist” or “mesh” account of the will, since a will is free if it has a certain internal structure or “mesh” among the various levels of desires and volitions. According to the hierarchical model, agents can have different kinds of desires. Some desires are desires to do a particular action; for example, Allison may desire to go jogging. Call these desires “1st order desires.” But even if Allison doesn’t desire to go jogging, she may nevertheless desire to be the kind of person who desires to go jogging. In other words, she may desire to have a certain 1st order desire. Call desires of this sort “2nd order desires.” If agents also have further desires to have particular 2nd order desires, one could construct a seemingly infinite hierarchy of desires.

Not all of an agent’s desires result in action. In fact, if one has conflicting desires, then it is impossible for an agent to satisfy all her desires. Suppose that Allison not only desires to run, but that she also desires to stay curled up in bed, where it is nice and warm. In such a case, Allison cannot fulfill both of her 1st order desires. If Allison decides to act on her desire to run, we say that her desire to run has moved her to action. An effective desire of this sort is called a volition; a volition is a desire that moves the agent all the way to action. Similarly, one can differentiate between a mere 2nd order desire (simply a desire to have a certain desire) and a 2nd order volition (a desire for a desire to become one’s will, or a desire for a desire to become a volition). According to the hierarchical view of the will, free will consists in having 2nd order volitions. In other words, an agent has a free will if she is able to have the sort of will that she wants to have. An agent acts on her own free will if her action is the result of a 1st order desire that she wants to become a 1st order volition.

Hierarchical views of the will are problematic, however, because it looks as if certain sorts of questionable manipulation can be compatible with this view’s account of free will. According to the view under consideration, Allison has free will with regard to going jogging if she has a 2nd order desire that her 1st order desire to go jogging will move her to go jogging. Nothing in this account, however, depends on how she got these desires. Even if she were manipulated, via brainwashing, for example, into having her 2nd order desire for her 1st order desire to go running become her will, Allison has the right “mesh” between her various orders of desires to qualify as having free will. This is an untoward consequence. While more robust hierarchical accounts of the will have the resources for explaining why Allison might not be free in this case, it is widely agreed that cases of manipulation and coercion are problematic for solely structural accounts of the will [see Ekstrom (1999), Fischer (1994), Kane, (2005), Pereboom (2001) and van Inwagen (1983)].

c. Reasons-Responsive View of the Will

A third treatment of free will takes as its starting point the claim that agency involves a sensitivity to certain reasons. An agent acts with free will if she is responsive to the appropriate rational considerations, and she does not act with a free will if she lacks such responsiveness. To see what such a view amounts to, consider again the case of Allison and her decision to walk her dog. A reasons-responsive view of the will says that Allison’s volition to walk her dog is free if, had she had certain reasons for not walking her dog, she would not have decided to walk her dog. Imagine what would have happened had Allison turned on the television after waking from her nap and learned of the blizzard before deciding to walk her dog. Had she known of the blizzard, she would have had a good reason for deciding not to walk her dog. Even if such reasons never occur to her (that is, if she doesn’t learn of the blizzard before her decision), her disposition to have such reasons influence her volitions shows that she is responsive to reasons. Thus, reasons-responsive views of the will are essentially dispositional in nature.

Coercion and manipulation undermine free will, on this view, in virtue of making agents not reasons-responsive. If Allison has been brainwashed to walk the dog at a certain time, then even if she were to turn on the news and sees that it is snowing, she would attempt to walk the dog despite having good reasons not to. Thus, manipulated agents are not reasons-responsive, and in virtue of this lack free will. [See Fischer and Ravizza (1998) for one of the primary reasons-responsive views of free will.]

3. Free Will and Determinism

a. The Thesis of Causal Determinism

Most contemporary scholarship on free will focuses on whether or not it is compatible with causal determinism. Causal determinism is sometimes also called “nomological determinism.” It is important to keep causal determinism distinct from other sorts of determinism, such as logical determinism or theological determinism (to be discussed below). Causal determinism (hereafter, simply “determinism”) is the thesis that the course of the future is entirely determined by the conjunction of the past and the laws of nature. Imagine a proposition that completely describes the way that the entire universe was at some point in the past, say 100 million years ago. Let us call this proposition “P.” Also imagine a proposition that expresses the conjunction of all the laws of nature; call this proposition “L.” Determinism then is the thesis that the conjunction of P and L entails a unique future. Given P and L, there is only one possible future, one possible way for things to end up. To make the same point using possible world semantics, determinism is the thesis that all the states of affairs that obtain at some time in the past, when conjoined with the laws of nature, entail which possible world is the actual world. Since a possible world includes those states of affairs that will obtain, the truth of determinism amounts to the thesis that the past and the laws of nature entail what states of affairs will obtain in the future, and that only those states of affairs entailed by the past and the laws will in fact obtain.

A system’s being determined is different from its being predictable. It is possible for determinism to be true and for no one to be able to predict the future. The fact that no human agent knows or is able to know future truths has no bearing on whether there are future truths entailed by the conjunction of the past and the laws. However, there is a weaker connection between the thesis of determinism and the predictability of the future. If determinism were true, then a being with a complete knowledge of P and L and with sufficient intellective capacities should be able to infallibly predict the way that the future will turn out. However, given that we humans lack both the relevant knowledge and the intellective capacities required, the fact that we are not able to predict the future is not evidence for the falsity of determinism.

b. Determinism, Science and “Near Determinism”

Most philosophers agree that whether or not determinism is true is a contingent matter; that is, determinism is neither necessarily true nor necessarily false. If this is so, then whether or not determinism is true becomes an empirical matter, to be discovered by investigating the way the world is, not through philosophical argumentation. This is not to deny that the truth of determinism would have metaphysical implications. For one, the truth of determinism would entail that the laws of nature are not merely probabilistic—for if they were, then the conjunction of the past and the laws would not entail a unique future. Furthermore, as we shall see shortly, philosophers care very much about what implications the truth of determinism would have for free will. But the point to note is that if the truth of determinism is a contingent truth about the way the world actually is, then scientific investigation should give us insight into this matter. Let us say that a possible world is deterministic if causal determinism is true in that world. There are two ways that worlds could fail to be deterministic. As already noted, if the laws of nature in a given world were probabilistic, then such a world would not be deterministic. Secondly, if there are entities within a world that are not fully governed by the laws of nature, then even if those laws are themselves deterministic, that world would not be deterministic.

Some scientists suggest that certain parts of physics give us reason to doubt the truth of determinism. For example, the standard interpretation of Quantum Theory, the Copenhagen Interpretation, holds that the laws governing nature are indeterministic and probabilistic. According to this interpretation, whether or not a small particle such as a quark swerves in a particular direction at a particular time is described properly only by probabilistic equations. Although the equations may predict the likelihood that a quark swerves to the left at a certain time, whether or not it actually swerves is indeterministic or random.

There are also deterministic interpretations of Quantum Theory, such as the Many-Worlds Interpretation. Fortunately, the outcome of the debate regarding whether Quantum Theory is most properly interpreted deterministically or indeterminstically, can be largely avoided for our current purposes. Even if (systems of) micro-particles such as quarks are indeterministic, it might be that (systems involving) larger physical objects such as cars, dogs, and people are deterministic. It is possible that the only indeterminism is on the scale of micro-particles and that macro-objects themselves obey deterministic laws. If this is the case, then causal determinism as defined above is, strictly speaking, false, but it is “nearly” true. That is, we could replace determinism with “near determinism,” the thesis that, despite quantum indeterminacy, the behaviors of all large physical objects—including all our actions—obey deterministic laws [see Honderich (2002), particularly chapter 6].

What would be the implications of the truth of either determinism or near determinism? More specifically, what would be the implications for questions of free will? One way to think about the implications would be by asking the following the question: Could we still be free even if scientists were to discover that causal determinism (or near determinism) is true?

c. Compatibilism, Incompatibilism, and Pessimism

The question at the end of the preceding section (Could we have free will even if determinism is true?) is a helpful way to differentiate the main positions regarding free will. Compatibilists answer this question in the affirmative. They believe that agents could have free will even if causal determinism is true (or even if near determinism is true. In what follows, I will omit this qualification). In other words, the existence of free will in a possible world is compatible with that world being deterministic. For this reason, this position is known as “compatibilism,” and its proponents are called “compatibilists.” According to the compatibilist, it is possible for an agent to be determined in all her choices and actions and still make some of her choices freely.

According to “incompatibilists,” the existence of free will is incompatible with the truth of determinism. If a given possible world is deterministic, then no agent in that world has free will for that very reason. Furthermore, if one assumes that having free will is a necessary condition for being morally responsible for one’s actions, then the incompatibility of free will and determinism would entail the incompatibility of moral responsibility and causal determinism.

There are at least two kinds of incompatibilists. Some incompatibilists think that determinism is true of the actual world, and thus no agent in the actual world possesses free will. Such incompatibilists are often called “hard determinists” [see Pereboom (2001) for a defense of hard determinism]. Other incompatibilists think that the actual world is not deterministic and that at least some of the agents in the actual world have free will. These incompatibilists are referred to as “libertarians” [see Kane (2005), particularly chapters 3 and 4]. However, these two positions are not exhaustive. It is possible that one is an incompatibilist, thinks that the actual world is not deterministic, and yet still thinks that agents in the actual world do not have free will. While it is less clear what to call such a position (perhaps “free will deniers”), it illustrates that hard determinism and libertarianism do not exhaust the ways to be an incompatibilist. Since all incompatibilists, whatever their stripe, agree that the falsity of determinism is a necessary condition for free will, and since compatibilists deny this assertion, the following sections speak simply of incompatibilists and compatibilists.

It is also important to keep in mind that both compatibilism and incompatibilism are claims about possibility. According to the compatibilist, it is possible that an agent is both fully determined and yet free. The incompatibilist, on the other hand, maintains that such a state of affairs is impossible. But neither position by itself is making a claim about whether or not agents actually do possess free will. Assume for the moment that incompatibilism is true. If the truth of determinism is a contingent matter, then whether or not agents are morally responsible will depend on whether or not the actual world is deterministic. Furthermore, even if the actual world is indeterministic, it doesn’t immediately follow that the indeterminism present is of the sort required for free will (we will return to a similar point below when considering an objection to incompatibilism). Likewise, assume both that compatibilism is true and that causal determinism is true in the actual world. It does not follow from this that agents in the actual world actually possess free will.

Finally, there are free will pessimists [see Broad (1952) and G. Strawson (1994)]. Pessimists agree with the incompatibilists that free will is not possible if determinism is true. However, unlike the incompatibilists, pessimists do not think that indeterminism helps. In fact, they claim, rather than helping support free will, indeterminism undermines it. Consider Allison contemplating taking her dog for a walk. According to the pessimist, if Allison is determined, she cannot be free. But if determinism is false, then there will be indeterminacy at some point prior to her action. Exactly where one locates this indeterminacy will depend on one’s particular view of the nature of free will. Let us assume that that indeterminacy is located in which reasons occur to Allison. It is hard to see, the pessimist argues, how this indeterminacy could enhance Allison’s free will, for the occurrence of her reasons is indeterministic, then having those reasons is not within Allison’s control. But if Allison decides on the basis of whatever reasons she does have, then her volition is based upon something outside of her control. It is based instead on chance. Thus, pessimists think that the addition of indeterminism actually makes agents lack the kind of control needed for free will. While pessimism might seem to be the same position as that advocated by free will deniers, pessimism is a stronger claim. Free will deniers thinks that while free will is possible, it just isn’t actual: agents in fact don’t have free will. Pessimists, however, have a stronger position, thinking that free will is impossible. Not only do agents lack free will, there is no way that they could have it [see G. Strawson (1994)]. The only way to preserve moral responsibility, for the pessimist, is thus to deny that free will is a necessary condition for moral responsibility.

As pessimism shows us, even a resolution to the debate between compatibilists and incompatibilists will not by itself solve the debate about whether or not we actually have free will. Nevertheless, it is to this debate that we now turn.

4. Arguments for Incompatibilism (or Arguments against Compatibilism)

Incompatibilists say that free will is incompatible with the truth of determinism. Not all arguments for incompatibilism can be considered here; let us focus on two major varieties. The first variety is built around the idea that having free will is a matter of having a choice about certain of our actions, and that having a choice is a matter of having genuine options or alternatives about what one does. The second variety of arguments is built around the idea that the truth of determinism would mean that we don’t cause our actions in the right kind of way. The truth of determinism would mean that we don’t originate our actions in a significant way and our actions are not ultimately controlled by us. In other words, we lack the ability for self-determination. Let us consider a representative argument from each set.

a. The Consequence Argument

The most well-known and influential argument for incompatibilism from the first set of arguments is called the “Consequence Argument,” and it has been championed by Carl Ginet and Peter van Inwagen [see Ginet (1966) and van Inwagen (1983)]. The Consequence Argument is based on a fundamental distinction between the past and the future. First, consider an informal presentation of this argument. There seems to be a profound asymmetry between the past and the future based on the direction of the flow of time and the normal direction of causation. The future is open in a way that the past is not. It looks as though there is nothing that Allison can now do about the fact that Booth killed Lincoln, given that Lincoln was assassinated by Booth in 1865.

This point stands even if we admit the possibility of time travel. For if time travel is possible, Allison can influence what the past became, but she cannot literally change the past. Consider the following argument:

The proposition “Lincoln was assassinated in 1865” is true.
If Allison travels to the past, she could prevent Lincoln from being assassinated in 1865 (temporarily assumed for reductio purposes).
If Allison were to travel to the past and prevent Lincoln from being assassinated in 1865, the proposition “Lincoln was assassinated in 1865” would be false.
A proposition cannot both be true and false.
Therefore, 2 is false.

So, at most the possibility of time travel allows for agents to have causal impact on the past, not for agents to change what has already become the past. The past thus appears to be fixed and unalterable. However, it seems that the same is not true of the future, for Allison can have an influence on the future through her volitions and subsequent actions. For example, if she were to invent a time machine, then she could, at some point in the future, get in her time machine and travel to the past and try to prevent Lincoln from being assassinated. However, given that he was assassinated, we can infer that her attempts would all fail. On the other hand, she could refrain from using her time machine in this way.

The asymmetry between past and future is illustrated by the fact that we don’t deliberate about the past in the same way that we deliberate about the future. While Allison might deliberate about whether a past action was really the best action that she could have done, she deliberates about the future in a different way. Allison can question whether her past actions were in fact the best, but she can both question what future acts would be best as well as which future acts she should perform. Thus, it looks like the future is open to Allison, or up to her, in a way that the past is not. In other words, when an agent like Allison is using her free will, what she is doing is selecting from a range of different options for the future, each of which is possible given the past and the laws of nature. For this reason, this view of free will is often called the “Garden of Forking Paths Model.”

The Consequence Argument builds upon this view of the fixed nature of the past to argue that if determinism is true, the future is not open in the way that the above reflections suggest. For if determinism is true, the future is as fixed as is the past. Remember from the above definition that determinism is the thesis the past (P) and the laws of nature (L) entail a unique future. Let “F” refer to any true proposition about the future. The Consequence argument depends on two modal operators, and two inference rules. Let the modal operator “☐” abbreviate “It is logically necessary that..,” so that, when it operates on some proposition p, “☐p” abbreviates “It is logically necessary that p.” Let the modal operator “N” be such that “Np” stands for “p is true and no one has, or ever had, any choice about whether p was true.” Call the following two inference rules “Alpha” and “Beta:”

Alpha: ☐p implies Np

Beta: {Np and N(p → q)} implies Nq

According to Alpha, if p is a necessary truth, then no one has, or ever had, any choice about whether p was true. Similarly, according to Beta, if no one has, or ever had, any choice about p being true, and no one has, or ever had, any choice that p entails q, then no one has, or ever had, any choice about whether q is true. To see the plausibility of Beta, consider the following application. Let p be the proposition “The earth was struck by a meteor weighing 100 metric tons one billion years ago,” and let q be the proposition “If the earth was struck by a meteor weighing 100 metric tons one billion years ago, then thousands of species went extinct.” Since I have no choice about such a meteor hitting in the past, and have no choice that if such meteor hits, it will cause thousands of species to go extinct, I have no choice that thousands of species went extinct. Beta thus looks extremely plausible. But if Beta is true, then we can construct an argument to show that if determinism is true, then I have no choice about anything, including my supposed free actions in the future. The argument begins with the definition of determinism given above:

(1) ☐{(P and L) → F}

Using a valid logical rule of inference (exportation), we can transform 1 into 2:

(2) ☐{P → (L → F)}

Applying Alpha, we can derive 3:

(3) N{P → (L → F)}

The second premise in the Consequence Argument is called the “fixity of the past.” No one has, or ever had, a choice about the true description P of the universe at some point in the distant past:

(4) NP

From 3, 4 and Beta, we can deduce 5:

(5) N(L → F)

The final premise in the argument is the fixity of the laws of nature. No one has, or ever had, a choice about what the laws of nature are (try as I might, I cannot make the law of universal gravitation not be a law of nature):

(6) NL

And from 5 and 6, again using Beta, we can infer that no one has, or ever had, a choice about F:

(7) NF

Given that F was any true proposition about the future, the Consequence Argument concludes that if determinism is true, then no one has or ever had a choice about any aspect of the future, including what we normally take to be our free actions. Thus, if determinism is true, we do not have free will.

b. The Origination Argument

The second general set of arguments for the incompatibility of free will and determinism builds on the importance of the source of a volition for free will. Again, it will be helpful to begin with an informal presentation of the argument before considering a formal presentation of it. According to this line of thought, an agent has free will when her volitions issue from the agent herself in a particular sort of way (say, her beliefs and desires). What is important for free will, proponents of this argument claim, is not simply that the causal chain for an agent’s volition goes through the agent, but that it originates with the agent. In other words, an agent acts with free will only if she originates her action, or if she is the ultimate source or first cause of her action [see Kane (1998)].

Consider again the claim that free will is a necessary condition for moral responsibility. What reflection on cases of coercion and manipulation suggests to us is that even if a coerced or manipulated agent is acting on her beliefs and desires, this isn’t enough for moral responsibility. We normally assume that coercion and certain forms of manipulation undercut an agent’s moral responsibility precisely because a coerced or manipulated agent isn’t the originator of her coerced action. If Allison is coerced into walking her dog via brainwashing, then her walking of the dog originates in the brainwashing, and not in Allison herself. Consider, then, the similarities between cases of coercion and manipulation, on the one hand, and the implications of the truth of determinism on the other. If determinism were true, it might be true that Allison chooses to walk her dog because of her beliefs and desires, but those beliefs and desires would themselves be the inevitable products of causal chains that began millions of years ago. Thus, a determined agent is at most a source, but not the ultimate source, of her volitions. According to proponents of this sort of argument for incompatibilism, the truth of determinism would mean that agents don’t cause their actions in the kind of way needed for free will and, ultimately, moral responsibility.

We can represent a formal version of the argument, called the “Origination Argument,” as follows:

An agent acts with free will only if she is the originator (or ultimate source) of her actions.
If determinism is true, then everything any agent does is ultimately caused by events and circumstances outside her control.
If everything an agent does is ultimately caused by events and circumstances beyond her control, then the agent is not the originator (or ultimate source) of her actions.
Therefore, if determinism is true, then no agent is the originator (or ultimate source) of her actions.
Therefore, if determinism is true, no agent has free will.

The Origination Argument is valid. So, in evaluating its soundness, we must evaluate the truth of its three premises. Premise 3 is clearly true, since for an agent to be an originator just is for that agent not to be ultimately determined by anything outside of herself. Premise 2 of this argument is true by the definition of determinism. To reject the conclusion of the argument, one must therefore reject premise 1.

Earlier we briefly noted one account of free will which implicitly denies premise 1, namely the hierarchical model of free will. According to this model, an agent acts with free will so long as the causal chain for that action goes through the agent’s 1st- and 2nd-order desires. One way of emphasizing the need for origination over-against such a hierarchical model is to embrace agent-causation. If premise 1 is true, then the agent’s volition cannot be the product of a deterministic causal chain extended beyond the agent. What other options are there? Two options are that volitions are uncaused, or only caused indeterministically. It is difficult to see how an agent could be the originator or ultimate source of volitions if volitions are uncaused. Similarly, for reasons we saw above when discussing the free will pessimist, it looks as if indeterministic causation would undermine, rather than enhance, an agent’s control over her volitions. For these reasons, some incompatibilists favor looking at the causation involved in volitions in a new light. Instead of holding that a volition is caused by a previous event (either deterministically or indeterministically), these incompatibilists favor saying that volitions are caused directly by agents. [For an extended defense of this view, see O’Connor, (2000).] They hold that there are two irreducibly different kinds of causation, event-causation and agent-causation, and the latter is involved in free will. Proponents of agent-causation propose that agents are enduring substances that directly possess the power to cause volitions. Although many philosophers question whether agent-causation is coherent, if it were coherent, then it would provide support for premise 1 of the Origination Argument.

c. The Relation between the Arguments

The above way of delineating the Consequence and Origination Arguments may unfortunately suggest that the two kinds of arguments are more independent from each other than they really are. A number of incompatibilists have argued that agents originate their actions in the way required by premise 1 of the Origination Argument if and only if they have a choice about their actions in the way suggested by the Consequence Argument. In other words, if my future volitions are not the sort of thing that I have a choice about, then I do not originate those volitions. And as the above arguments contend, the truth of causal determinism threatens both our control over our actions and volitions, and our ability to originate those same actions and volitions. For if causal determinism is true, then the distant past, when joined with the laws of nature, is sufficient for every volition that an agent makes, and the causal chains that lead to those volitions would not begin within the agent. Thus, most incompatibilists think that having a choice and being a self-determiner go hand-in-hand. Robert Kane, for instance, argues that if agents have “ultimate responsibility” (his term for what is here called “origination” or “self-determination”), then they will also have alternative possibilities open to them. According to this line of argumentation, the power to cause one’s own actions is not a distinct power from the power to choose and do otherwise. Thus, the two different kinds of arguments for incompatibilism may simply be two sides of the same coin [see Kane (1996) and (2005)].

5. Arguments for Compatibilism (or Arguments against Incompatibilism)

Having laid out representatives of the two most prominent arguments for incompatibilism, let’s consider arguments in favor of compatibilism. In considering these kinds of arguments, it is pedagogically useful to approach them by using the arguments for incompatibilism. So, this section begins by considering ways that compatibilists have responded to the arguments given in the preceding section.

a. Rejecting the Incompatibilist Arguments

As noted above, the Origination Argument for incompatibilism is valid, and two of its premises are above dispute. Thus, the only way for the compatibilist to reject the conclusion of the Origination Argument is to reject its first premise. In other words, given the definition of determinism, compatibilists must reject that free will requires an agent being the originator or ultimate source of her actions. But how might this be done? Most frequently, compatibilists motivate a rejection of the “ultimacy condition” of free will by appealing to either a hierarchical or reasons-responsive view of what the will is [see Frankfurt, (1971) and Fischer and Ravizza, (1998)]. If all that is required for free will, for example, is that a certain mesh between an agent’s 1st-order volitions and 2nd-order desires, then such an account does not require that an agent be the originator of those desires. Furthermore, since the truth of determinism would not entail that agents don’t have 1st and 2nd-order desires and volitions, a hierarchical account of the will is compatible with the truth of determinism. Similarly, if an agent has free will if she has the requisite level of reasons-responsiveness such that she would have willed differently had she had different reasons, ultimacy is again not required. Thus, if one adopts certain accounts of the will, one has reason for rejecting the central premise of the Origination Argument.

Compatibilists have a greater number of responses available to them with regard to the Consequence Argument. One way of understanding the N operator that figures in the Consequence Argument is in terms of having the ability to do otherwise. That is, to say that Allison has no choice about a particular action of hers is to say that she could not have performed a different action (or even no action at all). Incompatibilists can easily account for this ability to do otherwise. According to incompatibilists, an agent can be free only if determinism is false. Consider again the case of Allison. If determinism is false, even though Allison did choose to walk her dog, she could have done otherwise than walk her dog since the conjunction of P and L is not sufficient for her taking her dog for a walk. Compatibilists, however, can give their own account of the ability to do otherwise. For them, to say that Allison could have done otherwise is simply to say that Allison would have done otherwise had she willed or chosen to do so [see, for example, Chisholm (1967)]. Of course, if determinism is true, then the only way that Allison could have willed or chosen to do otherwise would be if either the past or the laws were different than they actually are. In other words, saying that an agent could have done otherwise is to say that the agent would have done otherwise in a different counterfactual condition. But saying this is entirely consistent with one way of understanding the ability to do otherwise. Thus, these compatibilists are saying that Allison has the ability to do something such that, had she done it, either the past or the laws of nature would have been different than they actually are. If P and L entail that the agent does some action A, then the agent’s doing otherwise than A entails that either P or L would have been different than they actually are. Some compatibilists favor saying that agents have this counterfactual power over the past, while others favor counterfactual power over the laws of nature [Compare Lewis (1981) and Fischer (1984)]. Regardless, adopting either strategy provides the compatibilist with a way of avoiding the conclusion of the Consequence Argument by denying either premise 4 or premise 6 of that argument. Furthermore, having such a power is not a hollow victory, for it demarcates a plausible difference between those actions an agent would have done even if she didn’t want to (as in the case of coercion or manipulation) from those actions that an agent only would have done had she had certain beliefs and desires about that action. This view thus differentiates between those actions that were within the agent’s power to bring about from those that were not.

A second compatibilist response to the Consequence Argument is to deny the validity of the inference rule Beta the argument uses. While there are several approaches to this, perhaps the most decisive is the following, called the principle of Agglomeration [see McKay and Johnson (1996)]. Using only the inference rules Alpha, Beta and the basic rule of logical replacement, one can show that

(1) Np

and

(2) Nq

would entail

(3) N(p and q)

if Beta were valid. 1 and 2 do not entail 3, so Beta must be invalid.

To see why 3 does not follow from 1 and 2, consider the case of a coin-toss. If the coin-toss is truly random, then Allison has no choice regarding whether the coin (if flipped) lands heads. Similarly, she has no choice regarding whether the coin (again, if flipped) lands tails. For purposes of simplicity, let us stipulate that the coin cannot land on its side and, if flipped, must land either heads or tails. Let p above represent ‘the coin doesn’t land heads’ and q represent ‘the coin doesn’t land tails’. If Beta were valid, then 1 and 2 would entail 3, and Allison would not have a choice about the conjunction of p and q; that is, she wouldn’t have a choice about the coin not landing heads and the coin not landing tails. If Allison didn’t have a choice about the coin not landing heads and didn’t have a choice about the coin not landing tails, then she wouldn’t have a choice about the coin landing either heads or tails. But Allison does have a choice about this—after all, she can ensure that the coin lands either heads or tails by simply flipping the coin. So Allison does have a choice about the conjunction of p and q. Since Alpha and the relevant rules of logical replacement in the transformation from Np and Nq to N(p and q) are beyond dispute, Beta must be invalid. Thus, the Consequent Argument for incompatibilism is invalid. [For an incompatibilist reply to the argument from Agglomeration, see Finch and Warfield (1998).]

b. Frankfurt’s Argument against “the Ability to Do Otherwise”

Two other arguments for compatibilism build on the freedom requirement for moral responsibility. If one can show that moral responsibility is compatible with the truth of determinism, and if free will is required for moral responsibility, one will have implicitly shown that free will is itself compatible with the truth of determinism. The first of these arguments for compatibilism rejects the understanding of having a choice as involving the ability to do otherwise mentioned above. While most philosophers have tended to accept that an agent can be morally responsible for doing an action only if she could have done otherwise, Harry Frankfurt has attempted to show that this requirement is in fact false. Frankfurt gives an example in which an agent does an action in circumstances that lead us to believe that the agent acted freely [Frankfurt (1969); for recent discussion, see Widerker and McKenna (2003)]. Yet, unbeknown to the agent, the circumstances include some mechanism that would bring about the action if the agent did not perform it on her own. As it happens, though, the agent does perform the action freely and the mechanism is not involved in bringing about the action. It thus looks like the agent is morally responsible despite not being able to do otherwise. Here is one such scenario:

Allison is contemplating whether to walk her dog or not. Unbeknown to Allison, her father, Lloyd, wants to insure that that she does decide to walk the dog. He has therefore implanted a computer chip in her head such that if she is about to decide not to walk the dog, the chip will activate and coerce her into deciding to take the dog for a walk. Given the presence of the chip, Allison is unable not to decide to walk her dog, and she lacks the ability to do otherwise. However, Allison does decide to walk the dog on her own.

In such a case, Frankfurt thinks that Allison is morally responsible for her decision since the presence of Lloyd and his computer chip play no causal role in her decision. Since she would have been morally responsible had Lloyd not been prepared to ensure that she decide to take her dog for a walk, why think that his mere presence renders her not morally responsible? Frankfurt concludes that Allison is morally responsible despite lacking the ability to do otherwise. If Frankfurt is right that such cases are possible, then even if the truth of determinism is incompatible with a kind of freedom that requires the ability to do otherwise, it is compatible with the kind of freedom required for moral responsibility.

c. Strawson’s Reactive Attitudes

In an influential article, Peter Strawson argues that many of the traditional debates between compatibilists and incompatibilists (such as how to understand the ability to do otherwise) are misguided [P. Strawson (1963)]. Strawson thinks that we should instead focus on what he calls the reactive attitudes—those attitudes we have toward other people based on their attitudes toward and treatment of us. Strawson says that the hallmark of reactive attitudes is that they are “essentially natural human reactions to the good or ill will or indifference of others toward us, as displayed in their attitudes and actions.” Examples of reactive attitudes include gratitude, resentment, forgiveness and love. Strawson thinks that these attitudes are crucial to the interpersonal interactions and that they provide the basis for holding individuals morally responsible. Strawson then argues for two claims. The first of these is that an agent’s reactive attitudes would not be affected by a belief that determinism was true:

The human commitment to participation in ordinary interpersonal relationships is, I think, too thoroughgoing and deeply rooted for us to take seriously the thought that a general theoretical conviction might so change our world that, in it, there were no longer such things as inter-personal relationships as we normally understand them.… A sustained objectivity of inter-personal attitude, and the human isolation which that would entail, does not seem to be something of which human beings would be capable, even if some general truth were a theoretical ground for it.

Furthermore, Strawson also argues for a normative claim: the truth of determinism should not undermine our reactive attitudes. He thinks that there are two kinds of cases where it is appropriate to suspend our reactive attitudes. One involves agents, such as young children or the mentally disabled, who are not moral agents. Strawson thinks that we should not have reactive attitudes toward non-moral agents. The second kind of case where it is appropriate to suspend our reactive attitudes are those in which while the agent is a moral agent, her action toward us is not connected to her agency in the correct way. For instance, while I might have the reactive attitude of resentment towards someone who bumps into me and makes me spill my drink, if I were to find out that the person was pushed into me, I would not be justified in resenting that individual. The truth of determinism, however, would neither entail that no agents are moral agents nor that none of an agent’s actions are connected to her moral agency. Thus, Strawson thinks, the truth of determinism should not undermine our reactive attitudes. Since moral responsibility is based on the reactive attitudes, Strawson thinks that moral responsibility is compatible with the truth of determinism. And if free will is a requirement for moral responsibility, Strawson’s argument gives support to compatibilism.

6. Related Issues

The above discussion should help explain the perennial attraction philosophers have to the issues surrounding free will, particularly as it relates to causal determinism. However, free will is also intimately related to a number of other recurrent issues in the history of philosophy. In this final section, I will briefly articulate two other kinds of determinism and show how they are connected to free will.

a. Theological Determinism

The debate about free will and causal determinism parallels, in many ways, another debate about free will, this one stemming from what is often called ‘theological determinism’. Some religious traditions hold that God is ultimately responsible for everything that happens. According to these traditions, God’s willing x is necessary and sufficient for x. But if He is ultimately responsible for everything in virtue of what He wills, then He is ultimately responsible for all the actions and volitions performed by agents. God’s willing that Allison take the dog for a walk is thus necessary and sufficient for Allison taking the dog for a walk. But if this is true, it is hard to see how Allison could have free will. The problem becomes especially astute when considering tradition doctrines of eternal punishment. The traditional Christian doctrine of Hell, for example, is that Hell is a place of eternal punishment for non-repentant sinners. But if theological determinism is true, then whether or not agents repent is ultimately up to God, not to the agents themselves. This worry over free will thus gives rise to a particular version of the problem of evil: why does God not will that all come to faith, when His having such a will is sufficient for their salvation? [For a discussion of these, and related issues, see Helm, (1994).]

b. Logical Determinism

In addition to the causal and theological forms of determinism, there is also logical determinism. Logical determinism builds off the law of excluded middle and holds that propositions about what agents will do in the future already have a truth value. For instance, the proposition “Allison will take the dog for a walk next Thursday” is already true or false. Assume that it is true. Since token propositions cannot change in truth value over time, it was true a million years ago that Allison would walk her dog next Thursday. But the truth of the relevant proposition is sufficient for her actually taking the dog for a walk (after all, if it is true that she will walk the dog, then she will walk the dog). But then it looks like no matter what happens, Allison will in fact take her dog for a walk next Thursday and that this has always been the case. However, it is hard to see how Allison’s deciding to walk the dog can be a free decision since she must (given that the relevant token proposition is true and was true a million years ago) decide to walk him. In response to this problem, some philosophers have attempted to show that free will is compatible with the existence of true propositions about what we will do in the future, and others have denied that propositions about future free actions have a truth value, that is, that the law of excluded middle fails for some propositions. [For an introduction to these issues, see Finch and Warfield, (1999) and Kane, (2002).] If God is a being who knows the truth value of every proposition, this debate also connects with the debate over the relationship between divine foreknowledge and free will.

From this brief survey, we see that free will touches on central issues in metaphysics, philosophy of human nature, action theory, ethics and the philosophy of religion. Furthermore, we’ve seen that there are competing views regarding virtually every aspect of free will (including whether there is, or even could be, such a thing). Perhaps this partially explains the perennial philosophical interest in the topic.

7. References and Further Reading

Anglin, W. S. (1990). Free Will and the Christian Faith (Clarendon Press).
Broad, C. D. (1952). “Determinism, Indeterminism, and Libertarianism,” in Ethics and the History of Philosophy (Routledge and Kegan Paul).
Chisholm, Roderick (1967). “He Could Have Done Otherwise,” Journal of Philosophy 64: 409-417.
Descartes, René (1998). Discourse on Method and Meditations on First Philosophy, 4th edition (Hackett Publishing Company).
Ekstrom, Laura Waddell (1999). Free Will: A Philosophical Study (HarperCollins Publishers).
Finch, Alicia and Ted Warfield (1994). “Fatalism: Logical and Theological,” Faith and Philosophy 16.2: 233-238.
Finch, Alicia and Ted Warfield (1998). “The Mind Argument and Libertarianism,” Mind 107: 515-528.
Fischer, John Martin (1984). “Power Over the Past,” Pacific Philosophical Quarterly 65: 335-350.
Fischer, John Martin (1994). The Metaphysics of Free Will (Blackwell).
Fischer, John Martin and Mark Ravizza (1998). Responsibility and Control: A Theory of Moral Responsibility (Cambridge University Press).
Frankfurt, Harry (1969). “Alternate Possibilities and Moral Responsibility,” reprinted in Pereboom, (1997), pages 156-166.
Frankfurt, Harry (1971). “Freedom of the Will and the Concept of a Person,” reprinted in Pereboom (1997), pages 167-183.
Ginet, Carl (1966). “Might We Have No Choice,” in Keith Lehrer, ed., Freedom and Determinism(Random House), pages 205-224.
Helm, Paul (1994). The Providence of God (InterVarsity Press).
Honderich, Ted (2002). How Free are You?, 2nd edition (Oxford University Press).
Kane, Robert (1998). The Significance of Free Will (Oxford University Press).
Kane, Robert, ed. (2001). Free Will (Blackwell).
Kane, Robert, ed. (2002). The Oxford Handbook of Free Will (Oxford University Press).
Kane, Robert (2005). A Contemporary Introduction to Free Will (Oxford University Press).
Lewis, David (1981). “Are We Free to Break the Laws?” Theoria 47: 113-121.
McKay, Thomas and David Johnson (1996). “A Reconsideration of an Argument against Compatibilism,” Philosophical Topics 24: 113-122.
O’Connor, Timothy (2000). Persons and Causes: The Metaphysics of Free Will (Oxford University Press).
Pereboom, Derk, ed. (1997). Free Will (Hackett).
Pereboom, Derk (2001). Living Without Free Will (Cambridge University Press).
Smilansky, Saul (2000). Free Will and Illusion (Clarendon Press).
Strawson, Galen (1994). “The Impossibility of Moral Responsibility,” Philosophical Studies 75: 5-24.
Strawson, Peter (1963). “Freedom and Resentment,” reprinted in Pereboom (1997), pages 119-142.
Stump, Eleonore (2003). Aquinas (Routledge).
Van Inwagen, Peter (1983). An Essay on Free Will (Clarendon Press).
Widerker, David and Michael McKenna (2003). Moral Responsibility and Alternative Possibilities: Essays on the Importance of Alternative Possibilities (Ashgate).

Author Information

Kevin Timpe
Email: ktimpe@nnu.edu
Northwest Nazarene University
U. S. A.

Analytic Philosophy

The school of analytic philosophy has dominated academic philosophy in various regions, most notably Great Britain and the United States, since the early twentieth century. It originated around the turn of the twentieth century as G. E. Moore and Bertrand Russell broke away from what was then the dominant school in the British universities, Absolute Idealism. Many would also include Gottlob Frege as a founder of analytic philosophy in the late 19th century, and this controversial issue is discussed in section 2c. When Moore and Russell articulated their alternative to Idealism, they used a linguistic idiom, frequently basing their arguments on the “meanings” of terms and propositions. Additionally, Russell believed that the grammar of natural language often is philosophically misleading, and that the way to dispel the illusion is to re-express propositions in the ideal formal language of symbolic logic, thereby revealing their true logical form. Because of this emphasis on language, analytic philosophy was widely, though perhaps mistakenly, taken to involve a turn toward language as the subject matter of philosophy, and it was taken to involve an accompanying methodological turn toward linguistic analysis. Thus, on the traditional view, analytic philosophy was born in this linguistic turn. The linguistic conception of philosophy was rightly seen as novel in the history of philosophy. For this reason analytic philosophy is reputed to have originated in a philosophical revolution on the grand scale—not merely in a revolt against British Idealism, but against traditional philosophy on the whole.

Analytic philosophy underwent several internal micro-revolutions that divide its history into five phases. The first phase runs approximately from 1900 to 1910. It is characterized by the quasi-Platonic form of realism initially endorsed by Moore and Russell as an alternative to Idealism. Their realism was expressed and defended in the idiom of “propositions” and “meanings,” so it was taken to involve a turn toward language. But its other significant feature is its turn away from the method of doing philosophy by proposing grand systems or broad syntheses and its turn toward the method of offering narrowly focused discussions that probe a specific, isolated issue with precision and attention to detail. By 1910, both Moore and Russell had abandoned their propositional realism—Moore in favor of a realistic philosophy of common sense, Russell in favor of a view he developed with Ludwig Wittgenstein called logical atomism. The turn to logical atomism and to ideal-language analysis characterizes the second phase of analytic philosophy, approximately 1910-1930. The third phase, approximately 1930-1945, is characterized by the rise of logical positivism, a view developed by the members of the Vienna Circle and popularized by the British philosopher A. J. Ayer. The fourth phase, approximately 1945-1965, is characterized by the turn to ordinary-language analysis, developed in various ways by the Cambridge philosophers Ludwig Wittgenstein and John Wisdom, and the Oxford philosophers Gilbert Ryle, John Austin, Peter Strawson, and Paul Grice.

During the 1960s, criticism from within and without caused the analytic movement to abandon its linguistic form. Linguistic philosophy gave way to the philosophy of language, the philosophy of language gave way to metaphysics, and this gave way to a variety of philosophical sub-disciplines. Thus the fifth phase, beginning in the mid 1960s and continuing beyond the end of the twentieth century, is characterized by eclecticism or pluralism. This post-linguistic analytic philosophy cannot be defined in terms of a common set of philosophical views or interests, but it can be loosely characterized in terms of its style, which tends to emphasize precision and thoroughness about a narrow topic and to deemphasize the imprecise or cavalier discussion of broad topics.

Even in its earlier phases, analytic philosophy was difficult to define in terms of its intrinsic features or fundamental philosophical commitments. Consequently, it has always relied on contrasts with other approaches to philosophy—especially approaches to which it found itself fundamentally opposed—to help clarify its own nature. Initially, it was opposed to British Idealism, and then to “traditional philosophy” at large. Later, it found itself opposed both to classical Phenomenology (for example, Husserl) and its offspring, such as Existentialism (Sartre, Camus, and so forth) and also “Continental”’ or “Postmodern” philosophy (Heidegger, Foucault and Derrida). Though classical Pragmatism bears some similarity to early analytic philosophy, especially in the work of C. S. Peirce and C. I. Lewis, the pragmatists are usually understood as constituting a separate tradition or school.

The Revolution of Moore and Russell: Cambridge Realism and The Linguistic Turn
Russell and the Early Wittgenstein: Ideal Language and Logical Atomism
Logical Positivism, the Vienna Circle, and Quine
1. Logical Positivism and the Vienna Circle
2. W. V. Quine
The Later Wittgenstein and Ordinary-Language Philosophy
1. Ordinary-Language Philosophy
2. The Later Wittgenstein
The 1960s and After: The Era of Eclecticism
References and Further Reading

1. The Revolution of Moore and Russell: Cambridge Realism and The Linguistic Turn

“It was towards the end of 1898,” wrote Bertrand Russell,

that Moore and I rebelled against both Kant and Hegel. Moore led the way, but I followed closely in his footsteps…. I felt…a great liberation, as if I had escaped from a hot house onto a windswept headland. In the first exuberance of liberation, I became a naïve realist and rejoiced in the thought that grass really is green. (Russell 1959, 22)

This important event in Russell’s own intellectual history turned out to be decisive for the history of twentieth-century philosophy as a whole; for it was this revolutionary break with British Idealism—then the most influential school of philosophical thought in the British universities—that birthed analytic philosophy and set it on the path to supplanting both Idealism and philosophy as traditionally conceived and practiced.

To understand Russell’s elation at the rebellion, one needs to know something about him and also something about British Idealism. Let’s begin with the latter.

At the end of the 19th century, F.H. Bradley, Bernard Bosanquet, and J.M.E. McTaggart were the leading British Idealists. They claimed that the world, although it naively appears to us to be a collection of discrete objects (this bird, that table, the earth and the sun, and so forth), is really a single indivisible whole whose nature is mental, or spiritual, or Ideal rather than material. Thus, idealism was a brand of metaphysical monism, but not a form of materialism, the other leading form of metaphysical monism. It was also a form of what we would now call anti-realism, since it claimed that the world of naïve or ordinary experience is something of an illusion. Their claim was not that the objects of ordinary experience do not exist, but that they are not, as we normally take them to be, discrete. Instead, every object exists and is what it is at least partly in virtue of the relations it bears to other things—more precisely, to all other things. This was called the doctrine of internal relations. Since, on this view, everything that exists does so only in virtue of its relations to everything else, it is misleading to say of any one thing that it exists simpliciter. The only thing that exists simpliciter is the whole—the entire network of necessarily related objects. Correspondingly, the Idealists believed that no statement about some isolated object could be true simpliciter, since, on their view, to speak of an object in isolation would be to ignore the greater part of the truth about it, namely, its relations to everything else.

Analytic philosophy began when Moore and then Russell started to defend a thoroughgoing realism about what Moore called the “common sense” or “ordinary” view of the world. This involved a lush metaphysical pluralism, the belief that there are many things that exist simpliciter. It was not this pluralism, however, nor the content of any of his philosophical views, that inspired the analytic movement. Instead, it was the manner and idiom of Moore’s philosophizing. First, Moore rejected system-building or making grand syntheses of his views, preferring to focus on narrowly defined philosophical problems held in isolation. Second, when Moore articulated his realism, he did so in the idiom of “propositions” and “meanings.” There is a noteworthy ambiguity as to whether these are linguistic items or mental ones.

This terminology is further ambiguous in Moore’s case, for two reasons. First, his views about propositions are highly similar to a view standard in Austro-German philosophy from Bolzano and Lotze to Husserl according to which “propositions” and “meanings” have an Ideal existence—the kind of existence traditionally attributed to Platonic Forms. It is likely that Moore got the idea from reading in that tradition (cf. Bell 1999, Willard 1984). Second, despite strong similarities with the Austro-German view, it is clear that, in Moore’s early thought, “propositions” and “meanings” are primarily neither Ideal nor mental nor linguistic, but real in the sense of “thing-like.” For Moore and the early Russell, propositions or meanings were “identical” to ordinary objects—tables, cats, people. For more on this peculiar view, see the article on Moore, section 2b.

The deep metaphysical complexity attaching to Moore’s view was largely overlooked or ignored by his younger contemporaries, who were attracted to the form of his philosophizing rather than to its content. Taking the linguistic aspect of “propositions” and “meanings” to be paramount, they saw Moore as endorsing a linguistic approach to philosophy. This along with his penchant for attending to isolated philosophical problems rather than constructing a grand system, gave rise to the notion that he had rebelled not merely against British Idealism but against traditional philosophy on the grand scale.

Though Moore was later to object that there was nothing especially linguistic about it (see Moore 1942b), the linguistic conception of Moore’s method was far from baseless. For instance, in a famous paper called “A Defense of Common Sense” (Moore 1925), Moore seems to argue that the common sense view of the world is built into the terms of our ordinary language, so that if some philosopher wants to say that some common sense belief is false, he thereby disqualifies the very medium in which he expresses himself, and so speaks either equivocally or nonsensically.

His case begins with the observation that we know many things despite the fact that we do not know how we know them. Among these “beliefs of common sense,” as he calls them, are such propositions as “There exists at present a living human body, which is my body,” “Ever since it [this body] was born, it has been either in contact with or not far from the surface of the earth,” and “I have often perceived both body and other things which formed part of its environment, including other human bodies” (Moore 1925; in Moore 1959: 33). We can call these common sense propositions.

Moore argues that each common sense proposition has an “ordinary meaning” that specifies exactly what it is that one knows when one knows that proposition to be true. This “ordinary meaning” is perfectly clear to most everyone, except for some skeptical philosophers who

seem to think that [for example] the question “Do you believe that the earth has existed for many years past?” is not a plain question, such as should be met either by a plain “Yes” or “No,” or by a plain “I can’t make up my mind,” but is the sort of question which can be properly met by: “It all depends on what you mean by ‘the earth’ and ‘exists’ and ‘years’….” (Moore 1925; in 1959: 36)

Moore thought that to call common sense into question this way is perverse because the ordinary meaning of a common sense proposition is plain to all competent language-users. So, to question its meaning, and to suggest it has a different meaning, is disingenuous. Moreover, since the bounds of intelligibility seem to be fixed by the ordinary meanings of common sense proposition, the philosopher must accept them as starting points for philosophical reflection. Thus, the task of the philosopher is not to question the truth of common sense propositions, but to provide their correct analyses or explanations.

Moore’s use of the term “analysis” in this way is the source of the name “analytic philosophy.” Early on in analytic history, Moorean analysis was taken to be a matter of rephrasing some common sense proposition so as to yield greater insight into its already-clear and unquestionable meaning. For example, just as one elucidates the meaning of “brother” by saying a brother is a male sibling or by saying it means “male sibling,” so one might say that seeing a hand means experiencing a certain external object—which is exactly what Moore claims in his paper “Proof of an External World” (Moore 1939).

The argument of that essay runs as follows. “Here is one hand” is a common sense proposition with an ordinary meaning. Using it in accordance with that meaning, presenting the hand for inspection is sufficient proof that the proposition is true—that there is indeed a hand there. But a hand, according to the ordinary meaning of “hand,” is a material object, and a material object, according to the ordinary meaning of “material object,” is an external object, an object that isn’t just in our mind. Thus, since we can prove that there is a hand there, and since a hand is an external object, there is an external world, according to the ordinary meaning of “external world.”

These examples are from papers written in the second half of Moore’s career, but his “linguistic method” can be discerned much earlier, in works dating all the way back to the late 1800s—the period of his rebellion against Idealism. Even in Moore’s first influential paper, “The Nature of Judgment” (Moore 1899), he can be found paying very close attention to propositions and their meanings. In his celebrated paper, “The Refutation of Idealism” (Moore 1903b), Moore uses linguistic analysis to argue against the Idealist’s slogan Esse est percipi (to be is to be perceived). Moore reads the slogan as a definition or, as he would later call it, an analysis: just as we say “bachelor” means “unmarried man,” so the Idealist says “to exist” means “to be cognized.” However, if these bits of language had the same meaning, Moore argues, it would be superfluous to assert that they were identical, just as it is superfluous to say “a bachelor is a bachelor.” The fact that the Idealist sees some need to assert the formula reveals that there is a difference in meanings of “to be” and “to be perceived,” and hence a difference in the corresponding phenomena as well.

Moore’s most famous meaning-centered argument is perhaps the “open question argument” of his Principia Ethica (Moore 1903a). The open question argument purports to show that it is a mistake to define “good” in terms of anything other than itself. For any definition of good—“goodness is pleasure,” say—it makes sense to ask whether goodness really is pleasure (or whatever it has been identified with); thus, every attempt at definition leaves it an open question as to what good really is. This is so because every purported definition fails to capture the meaning of “good.”

All of these cases exhibit what proved to be the most influential aspect of Moore’s philosophical work, namely his method of analysis, which many of his contemporaries took to be linguistic analysis. For instance, Norman Malcolm represents the standard view of Moore for much of the twentieth century when he says that “the essence of Moore’s technique of refuting philosophical statements consists in pointing out that these statements go against ordinary language” (Malcolm 1942, 349). In the same essay, he goes on to tie Moore’s entire philosophical legacy to his “linguistic method:”

Moore’s great historical role consists in the fact that he has been perhaps the first philosopher to sense that any philosophical statement that violates ordinary language is false, and consistently to defend ordinary language against its philosophical violators. (Malcolm 1942, 368)

Malcolm is right to note the novelty of Moore’s approach. Although previous philosophers occasionally had philosophized about language, and had, in their philosophizing, paid close attention to the way language was used, none had ever claimed that philosophizing itself was merely a matter of analyzing language. Of course, Moore did not make this claim either, but what Moore actually did as a philosopher seemed to make saying it superfluous—in practice, he seemed to be doing exactly what Malcolm said he was doing. Thus, though it took some time for the philosophical community to realize it, it eventually became clear that this new “linguistic method,” pioneered by Moore, constituted a radical break not only with the British Idealists but with the larger philosophical tradition itself. To put it generally, philosophy was traditionally understood as the practice of reasoning about the world. Its goal was to give a logos—a rationally coherent account—of the world and its parts at various levels of granularity, but ultimately as a whole and at the most general level. There were other aspects of the project, too, of course, but this was the heart of it. With Moore, however, philosophy seemed to be recast as the practice of linguistic analysis applied to isolated issues. Thus, the rise of analytic philosophy, understood as the relatively continuous growth of a new philosophical school originating in Moore’s “linguistic turn,” was eventually recognized as being not just the emergence of another philosophical school, but as constituting a “revolution in philosophy” at large. (See Ayer et al. 1963 and Tugendhat 1982.)

2. Russell and the Early Wittgenstein: Ideal Language and Logical Atomism

The second phase of analytic philosophy is charaterized by the turn to ideal language analysis and, along with it, logical atomism—a metaphysical system developed by Bertrand Russell and Ludwig Wittgenstein. Russell laid the essential groundwork for both in his pioneering work in formal logic, which is covered in Sections 2a and 2b. Though this work was done during the first phase of analytic philosophy (1900-1910), it colaesced into a system only toward the end of that period, as Russell and Whitehead completed their work on the monumental Principia Mathematica (Russell and Whitehead 1910-13), and as Russell began to work closely with Ludwig Wittgenstein.

Wittgenstein seems to have been the sine qua non of the system. Russell was the first to use the term “logical atomism,” in a 1911 lecture to the French Philosophical Society. He was also the first to publicly provide a full-length, systematic treatment of it, in his 1918 lectures on “The Philosophy of Logical Atomism” (Russell 1918-19). However, despite the centrality of Russell’s logical work for the system, in the opening paragraph of these lectures Russell acknowedges that they “are very largely concerned with explaining certain ideas which I learnt from my friend and former pupil Ludwig Wittgenstein” (Russell 1918, 35). Wittgenstein’s own views are recorded in his Tractatus Logico-Philosophicus. First published in 1921, the Tractatus proved to be the most influential piece written on logical atomism. Because of its influence, we shall pay special attention to the Tractatus when it comes to presenting logical atomism as a complete system in Section 2d.

Though Russell and Wittgenstein differed over some of the details of logical atomism, these disagreements can be ignored for present purposes. What mattered for the development of analytic philosophy on the whole was the emergence in the second decade of the twentieth century of a new view of reality tailored to fit recent developments in formal logic and the philosophical methodology connected to it, as discussed in Section 2b. This was the common core of the Russellian and Wittegensteinian versions of logical atomism; thus, blurring the lines between Russell and Wittgenstein actually enables us to maintain better focus on the emerging analytic tradition. It will also make convenient a brief word on Frege, to see why some have wanted to include him as a founder of analytic philosophy (Section 2c).

a. The Theory of Descriptions

Much of Russell’s exuberance over Moore’s realism had to do with its consequences for logic and mathematics. Like so many philosophers before him, Russell was attracted to the objective certainty of mathematical and logical truths. However, because Idealism taught that no proposition about a bit of reality in isolation could be true simpliciter, an apparently straightforward truth such as 2+2=4, or If a=b and b=c then a=c, was not so straightforward after all. Even worse, Idealism made such truths dependent upon their being thought or conceived. This follows from the doctrine of internal relations; for, on the natural assumption that knowledge is or involves a relation between a knower (subject) and something known (object), the doctrine implies that objects of knowledge are not independent of the subjects that know them. This left Idealism open to the charge of endorsing psychologism—the view that apparently objective truths are to be accounted for in terms of the operations of subjective cognitive or “psychological” faculties. Psychologism was common to nearly all versions of Kantian and post-Kantian Idealism (including British Idealism). It was also a common feature of thought in the British empirical tradition, from Hume to Mill (albeit with a naturalistic twist). Moore’s early realism allowed Russell to avoid psychologism and other aspects of Idealism that prevented treating logical and mathematical truths as absolutely true in themselves.

A crucial part of this early realism, however, was the object theory of meaning; and this had implications that Russell found unacceptable. On the object theory, the meaning of a sentence is the object or state of affairs to which it refers (this is one reason why Moore could identify ordinary objects as propositions or meanings; see Section 1). For instance, the sentence “That leaf is green” is meaningful in virtue of bearing a special relationship to the state of affairs it is about, namely, a certain leaf’s being green.

This may seem plausible at first glance; problems emerge, however, when one recognizes that the class of meaningful sentences includes many that, from an empirical point of view, lack objects. Any statement referring to something that does not exist, such as a fictional character in a novel, will have this problem. A particularly interesting species of this genus is the negative existential statement—statements that express the denial of their subjects’ existence. For example, when we say “The golden mountain does not exist,” we seem to refer to a golden mountain—a nonexistent object—in the very act of denying its existence. But, on the object theory, if this sentence is to be meaningful, it must have an object to serve as its meaning. Thus it seems that the object theorist is faced with a dilemma: either give-up the object theory of meaning or postulate a realm of non-empirical objects that stand as the meanings of these apparently objectless sentences.

The Austrian philosopher Alexius Meinong took the latter horn of the dilemma, notoriously postulating a realm of non-existent objects. This alternative was too much for Russell. Instead, he found a way of going between the horns of the dilemma. His escape route was called the “theory of descriptions,” a bit of creative reasoning that the logician F. P. Ramsey called a “paradigm of philosophy,” and one which helped to stimulate extraordinary social momentum for the budding analytic movement. The theory of descriptions appears in Russell’s 1905 essay, “On Denoting,” which has become a central text in the analytic canon. There, Russell argues that “denoting phrases”—phrases that involve a noun preceded by “a,” “an,” “some,” “any,” “every,” “all,” or “the”—are incomplete symbols; that is, they have no meaning on their own, but only in the context of a complete sentence that expresses a proposition. Such sentences can be rephrased—analyzed in Moore’s sense of “analyzed”—into sentences that are meaningful and yet do not refer to anything nonexistent.

For instance, according to Russell, saying “The golden mountain does not exist” is really just a misleading way of saying “It is not the case that there is exactly one thing that is a mountain and is golden.” Thus analyzed, it becomes clear that the proposition does not refer to anything, but simply denies an existential claim. Since it does not refer to any “golden mountain,” it does not need a Meinongian object to provide it with meaning. In fact, taking the latter formulation to be the true logical form of the statement, Russell construes the original’s reference to a non-existent golden mountain as a matter of grammatical illusion. One dispels the illusion by making the grammatical form match the true logical form, and this is done through logical analysis. The idea that language could cast illusions that needed to be dispelled, some form of linguistic analysis was to be a prominent theme in analytic philosophy, both in its ideal language and ordinary language camps, through roughly 1960.

b. Ideal-Language Philosophy vs. Ordinary-Language Philosophy

Russellian analysis has just been just identified as logical rather than linguistic analysis, and yet it was said in a previous paragraph that this was analysis in the sense made familiar by Moore. In truth, there were both significant similarities and significant differences between Moorean and Russellian analysis. On the one hand, Russellian analysis was like Moore’s in that it involved the rephrasing of a sentence into another sentence semantically equivalent but grammatically different. On the other hand, Russell’s analyses were not given in ordinary language, as Moore’s were. Instead, they were given in symbolic logic, that is, in a quasi-mathematical, symbolic notation that made the structure of Russell’s analyzed propositions exceedingly clear. For instance, with the definitions of Mx as “x is a mountain” and Gx as “x is golden,” the proposition that the golden mountain does not exist becomes

~[(∃x)(Mx & Gx) & ∀y((My & Gy) → y=x)]

Equivalently, in English, it is not the case that there is some object such that (1) it is a mountain, (2) it is golden, and (3) all objects that are mountains and golden are identical to it. (For more on what this sort of notation looks like and how it works, see the article on Propositional Logic, especially Section 3.)

By 1910, Russell, along with Alfred North Whitehead, had so developed this symbolic notation and the rules governing its use that it constituted a fairly complete system of formal logic. This they published in the three volumes of their monumental Principia Mathematica (Russell and Whitehead 1910-1913).

Within the analytic movement, the Principia was received as providing an ideal language, capable of elucidating all sorts of ordinary-language confusions. Consequently, Russellian logical analysis was seen as a new species of the genus linguistic analysis, which had already been established by Moore. Furthermore, many took logical analysis to be superior to Moore’s ordinary-language analysis insofar as its results (its analyses) were more exact and not themselves prone to further misunderstandings or illusions.

The distinction between ordinary-language philosophy and ideal-language philosophy formed the basis for a fundamental division within the analytic movement through the early 1960s. The introduction of logical analysis also laid the groundwork for logical atomism, a new metaphysical system developed by Russell and Ludwig Wittgenstein. Before we discuss this directly, however, we must say a word about Gottlob Frege.

c. Frege: Influence or Instigator?

In developing the formal system of Principia Mathematica, Russell relied heavily on the work of several forebears including the German mathematician and philosopher Gottlob Frege. A generation before Russell and the Principia, Frege had provided his own system of formal logic, with its own system of symbolic notation. Frege’s goal in doing so was to prove logicism, the view that mathematics is reducible to logic. This was also Russell’s goal in the Principia. (For more on the development of logic in the late 19th and early 20th centuries, see the article on Propositional Logic, especially Section 2). Frege also anticipated Russell’s notion of incomplete symbols by invoking what has come to be called “the context principle:” words have meaning only in the context of complete sentences.

Frege’s focus on the formalization and symbolization of logic naturally led him into terrain that we would now classify as falling under the philosophy of language, and to approach certain philosophical problems as if they were problems about language, or at least as if they could be resolved by linguistic means. This has led some to see in Frege a linguistic turn similar to that perceivable in the early work of Moore and Russell (on this point, see the article on Frege and Language).

Because of these similarities and anticipations, and because Russell explicitly relied on Frege’s work, many have seen Frege as a founder of analytic philosophy more or less on a par with Moore and Russell (See Dummett 1993 and Kenny 2000). Others see this as an exaggeration both of Frege’s role and of the similarities between him and other canonical analysts. For instance, Peter Hacker notes that Frege was not interested in reforming philosophy the way all the early analysts were:

Frege’s professional life was a single-minded pursuit of a demonstration that arithmetic had its foundations in pure logic alone … One will search Frege’s works in vain for a systematic discussion of the nature of philosophy. (Hacker 1986: 5, 7)

There is no doubt that Frege’s views proved crucially useful and inspiring to key players on the ideal-language side of analytic philosophy. Whether or not this qualifies him as a founder of analytic philosophy depends on the extent to which we see the analytic movement as born of a desire for metaphilosophical revolution on the grand scale. To the extent that this is essential to our understanding of analytic philosophy, Frege’s role will be that of an influence rather than a founder.

d. Logical Atomism and Wittgenstein’s Tractatus

Ludwig Wittgenstein came to Cambridge to study mathematical logic under Russell, but he quickly established himself as his teacher’s intellectual peer. Together, they devised a metaphysical system called “logical atomism.” As discussed at the beginning of Section 2, qua total system, logical atomism seems to have been Wittgenstein’s brainchild. Still, this should not be seen as in any way marginalizing Russell’s significance for the system, which can be described as a metaphysics based on the assumption that an ideal language the likes of which was provided in Principia Mathematica is the key to reality.

According to logical atomism, propositions are built out of elements corresponding to the basic constituents of the world, just as sentences are built out of words. The combination of words in a meaningful sentence mirrors the combination of constituents in the corresponding proposition and also in the corresponding possible or actual state of affairs. That is, the structure of every possible or actual state of affairs is isomorphic with both the structure of the proposition that refers to it and the structure of the sentence that expresses that proposition–so long as the sentence is properly formulated in the notation of symbolic logic. The simplest sort of combination is called an atomic fact because this fact has no sub-facts as part of its structure. An atomic fact for some logical atomists might be something like an individual having a property—a certain leaf’s being green, for instance. Linguistically, this fact is represented by an atomic proposition: for example, “this leaf is green,” or, in logical symbolism “F(a).” Both the fact F(a) and the proposition “F(a)” are called “atomic” not because they themselves are atomic [that is, without structure], but because all their constituents are. Atomic facts are the basic constituents of the world, and atomic propositions are the basic constituents of language.

More complex propositions representing more complex facts are called molecular propositions and molecular facts. The propositions are made by linking atomic propositions together with truth-functional connectives, such as “and,” “or” and “not.” A truth-functional connective is one that combines constituent propositions in such a way that their truth-values (that is, their respective statuses as true or false) completely determine the truth value of the resulting molecular proposition. For instance, the truth value of a proposition of the form “not-p” can be characterized in terms of, and hence treated as determined by, the truth value of “p” because if “p” is true, then “not-p” is false, and if it is false, “not-p” is true. Similarly, a proposition of the form “p and q” will be true if and only if its constituent propositions “p” and “q” are true on their own.

The logic of Principia Mathematica is entirely truth-functional; that is, it only allows for molecular propositions whose truth-values are determined by their atomic constituents. Thus, as Russell observed in the introduction to the second edition of the Principia, “given all true atomic propositions, together with the fact that they are all, every other true proposition can theoretically be deduced by logical methods” (Russell 1925, xv). The same assumption—called the thesis of truth-functionality or the thesis of extensionality—lies behind Wittgenstien’s Tractatus Logico-Philosophicus.

As mentioned previously, Wittgenstein’s Tractatus proved to be the most influential expression of logical atomism. The Tractatus is organized around seven propositions, here taken from the 1922 translation by C. K. Ogden:

The world is everything that is the case.
What is the case, the fact, is the existence of atomic facts.
The logical picture of the facts is the thought.
The thought is the significant proposition.
Propositions are truth-functions of elementary propositions. (An elementary proposition is a truth function of itself.)
The general form of a truth-function is…. This is the general form of a proposition.
Whereof one cannot speak, thereof one must be silent.

The body of the Tractatus consists in cascading levels of numbered elaborations of these propositions (1 is elaborated by 1.1 which is elaborated by 1.11, 1.12 and 1.13, and so forth)—except for 7, which stands on its own. Propositions 1 and 2 establish the metaphysical side of logical atomism: the world is nothing but a complex of atomic facts. Propositions 3 and 4 establish the isomorphism between language and reality: a significant (meaningful) proposition is a “logical picture” of the facts that constitute some possible or actual state of affairs. It is a picture in the sense that the structure of the proposition is identical to the structure of the corresponding atomic facts. It is here, incidentally, that we get the first explicit statement of the metaphilosophical view characteristic of early analytic philosophy: “All philosophy is a ‘critique of language’ …” (4.0031).

Proposition 5 asserts the thesis of truth-functionality, the view that all complex propositions are built out of atomic propositions joined by truth-functional connectives, and that atomic propositions are truth-functional in themselves. Even existentially quantified propositions are considered to be long disjunctions of atomic propositions. It has since been recognized that a truth-functional logic is not adequate to capture all the phenomena of the world; or at least that, if there is an adequate truth-functional system, we haven’t found it yet. Certain phenomena seem to defy truth-functional characterization; for instance, moral facts are problematic. Knowing whether the constituent proposition “p” is true, doesn’t seem to tell us whether “It ought to be the case that p” is true. Similarly problematical are facts about thoughts, beliefs, and other mental states (captured in statements such as “John believes that…”), and modal facts (captured in statements about the necessity or possibility of certain states of affairs). And treating existential quantifiers as long disjunctions doesn’t seem to be adequate for the infinite number of facts about numbers since there surely are more real numbers than there are available names to name them even if we were willing to accept infinitely long disjunctions. The hope that truth-functional logic will prove adequate for resolving all these problems has inspired a good bit of thinking in the analytic tradition, especially during the first half of the twentieth century. This hope lies at the heart of logical atomism.

In its full form, Proposition 6 includes some unusual symbolism that is not reproduced here. All it does, however, is to give a general “recipe” for the creation of molecular propositions by giving the general form of a truth-function. Basically, Wittgenstein is saying that all propositions are truth-functional, and that, ultimately, there is only one kind of truth-function. Principia Mathematica had employed a number of truth-functional connectives: “and,” “or,” “not,” and so forth. However, in 1913 a logician named Henry Sheffer showed that propositions involving these connectives could be rephrased (analyzed) as propositions involving a single connective consisting in the negation of a conjunction. This was called the “not and” or “nand” connective, and was supposed to be equivalent to the ordinary language formulation “not both x and y.” It is usually symbolized by a short vertical line ( | ) called the Sheffer stroke. Though Wittgenstein uses his own idiosyncratic symbolism, this is the operation identified in proposition 6 and some of its elaborations as showing the general form of a truth-function. Replacing the Principia’s plurality of connectives with the “nand” connective made for an extremely minimalistic system—all one needed to construct a complete picture/description of the world was a single truth-functional connective applied repeatedly to the set of all atomic propositions.

Proposition 7, which stands on its own, is the culmination of a series of observations made throughout the Tractatus, and especially in the elaborations of proposition 6. Throughout the Tractatus there runs a distinction between showing and saying. Saying is a matter of expressing a meaningful proposition. Showing is a matter of presenting something’s form or structure. Thus, as Wittgenstein observes at 4.022, “A proposition shows its sense. A proposition shows how things stand if it is true. And it says that they do so stand.”

In the introduction to the Tractatus, Wittgenstein indicates that his overarching purpose is to set the criteria and limits of meaningful saying. The structural aspects of language and the world—those aspects that are shown—fall beyond the limits of meaningful saying. According to Wittgenstein, the propositions of logic and mathematics are purely structural and therefore meaningless—they show the form of all possible propositions/states of affairs, but they do not themselves picture any particular state of affairs, thus they do not say anything. This has the odd consequence that the propositions of the Tractatus themselves, which are supposed to be about logic, are meaningless. Hence the famous dictum at 6.54:

My propositions are elucidatory in this way: he who understands me finally recognizes them as senseless, when he has climbed out through them, on them, over them. (He must so to speak throw away the ladder, after he has climbed up on it.) He must transcend these propositions, and then he will see the world aright.

Though meaningless, the propositions of logic and mathematics are not nonsense. They at least have the virtue of showing the essential structure of all possible facts. On the other hand, there are concatenations of words, purported propositions, that neither show nor say anything and thus are not connected to reality in any way. Such propositions are not merely senseless, they are nonsense. Among nonsense propositions are included the bulk of traditional philosophical statements articulating traditional philosophical problems and solutions, especially in metaphysics and ethics. This is the consequence of Wittgenstein’s presumption that meaningfulness is somehow linked to the realm of phenomena studied by the natural sciences (cf. 4.11 ff). Thus, as he claims in 6.53:

The correct method in philosophy would really be the following: to say nothing except what can be said, that is propositions of natural science—that is something that has nothing to do with philosophy—and then, whenever someone else wanted to say something metaphysical, to demonstrate to him that he had failed to give a meaning to certain signs in his propositions.

In the eyes of its author (as he avers in its Introduction), the real accomplishment of the Tractatus was to have solved, or rather dissolved, all the traditional problems of philosophy by showing that they were meaningless conundrums generated by a failure to understand the limits of meaningful discourse.

3. Logical Positivism, the Vienna Circle, and Quine

a. Logical Positivism and the Vienna Circle

Logical positivism is the result of combining the central aspects of the positivisms of Auguste Comte and Ernst Mach with the meta-philosophical and methodological views of the analytic movement, especially as understood by the ideal-language camp. In all its forms, positivism was animated by the idealization of scientific knowledge as it was commonly understood from at least the time of Newton through the early twentieth century. Consequently, at its core is a view called scientism: the view that all knowledge is scientific knowledge.

As twentieth-century philosophy of science has shown, the definition and demarcation of science is a very difficult task. Still, for several centuries it has been common to presume that metaphysics and other branches of philosophy-as-traditionally-practiced, not to mention religious and “common sense” beliefs, do not qualify as scientific. From the standpoint of scientism, these are not fields of knowledge, and their claims should not be regarded as carrying any serious weight.

At the heart of logical positivism was a novel way of dismissing certain non-scientific views by declaring them not merely wrong or false, but meaningless. According to the verification theory of meaning, sometimes also called the empiricist theory of meaning, any non-tautological statement has meaning if and only if it can be empirically verified. This “verification principle” of meaning is similar to the principle maintained in Wittgenstein’s Tractatus that the realm of meaning is coextensive with the realm of the natural (empirical) sciences. In fact the logical positivists drew many of their views straight from the pages of the Tractatus (though their reading of it has since been criticized as being too inclined to emphasize the parts friendly to scientific naturalism at the expense of those less-friendly). With Wittgenstein, the logical positivists concluded that the bulk of traditional philosophy consisted in meaningless pseudo-problems generated by the misuse of language, and that the true role of philosophy was to establish and enforce the limits of meaningful language through linguistic analysis.

Logical positivism was created and promoted mainly by a number of Austro-German thinkers associated with the Vienna Circle and, to a lesser extent, the Berlin Circle. The Vienna Circle began as a discussion group of scientifically-minded philosophers—or perhaps philosophically minded-scientists—organized by Moritz Schlick in 1922. Its exact membership is difficult to determine, since there were a number of peripheral figures who attended its meetings or at least had substantial connections to core members, but who are frequently characterized as visitors or associates rather than full-fledged members. Among its most prominent members were Schlick himself, Otto Neurath, Herbert Feigl, Freidrich Waismann and, perhaps most prominent of all, Rudolph Carnap. The members of both Circles made contributions to a number of different philosophical and scientific discussions, including logic and the philosophy of mind (see for example this Encyclopedia’s articles on Behaviorism and Identity Theory); however, their most important contributions vis-à-vis the development of analytic philosophy were in the areas of the philosophy of language, philosophical methodology and metaphilosophy. It was their views in these areas that combined to form logical positivism.

Logical positivism was popularized in Britain by A.J. Ayer, who visited with the Vienna Circle in 1933. His book Language, Truth and Logic (Ayer 1936) was extremely influential, and remains the best introduction to logical positivism as understood in its heyday. To escape the turmoil of World War II, several members of the Vienna Circle emigrated to the United States where they secured teaching posts and exercised an immense influence on academic philosophy. By this time, however, logical positivism was largely past its prime; consequently, it was not so much logical positivism proper that was promulgated, but something more in the direction of philosophizing focused on language, logic, and science. (For more on this point, see the article on American Philosophy, especially Section 4).

Ironically, the demise of logical positivism was caused mainly by a fatal flaw in its central view, the verification theory of meaning. According to the verification principle, a non-tautological statement has meaning if and only if it can be empirically verified. However, the verification principle itself is non-tautological but cannot be empirically verified. Consequently, it renders itself meaningless. Even apart from this devastating problem, there were difficulties in setting the scope of the principle so as to properly subserve the positivists’ scientistic aims. In its strong form (given above), the principle undermined not only itself, but also statements about theoretical entities, so necessary for science to do its work. On the other hand, weaker versions of the principle, such as that given in the second edition of Ayer’s Language, Truth, and Logic (1946), were incapable of eliminating the full range of metaphysical and other non-scientific statements that the positivists wanted to disqualify.

b. W. V. Quine

Willard Van Orman Quine was the first American philosopher of any great significance in the analytic tradition. Though his views had their greatest impact only as the era of linguistic philosophy came to an end, it is convenient to take them up in contrast with logical positivism.

An important part of the logical positivist program was the attempt to analyze or reduce scientific statements into so-called protocol statements having to do with empirical observations. This reductionist project was taken up by several members of the Vienna Circle, but none took it so far as did Rudolph Carnap, in his The Logical Structure of the World (1928) and in subsequent work.

The basic problem for the reductionist project is that many important scientific claims and concepts seem to go beyond what can be verified empirically. Claiming that the sun will come up tomorrow is a claim the goes beyond today’s observations. Claims about theoretical entities such as atoms also provide obvious cases of going beyond what can be verified by specific observations, but statements of scientific law run into essentially the same problem. Assuming empiricism, what is required to place scientific claims on a secure, epistemic foundation is to eliminate the gap between observation and theory without introducing further unverifiable entities or views. This was the goal of the reductionist project. By showing that every apparently unverifiable claim in science could be analyzed into a small set of observation-sentences, the logical positivists hoped to show that the gap between observation and theory does not really exist.

Despite being on very friendly terms with Carnap and other members of the Vienna Circle (with whom he visited in the early 1930s), and despite being dedicated, as they were, to scientism and empiricism, Quine argued that the reductionist project was hopeless. “Modern Empiricism,” he claimed,

has been conditioned in large part by two dogmas. One is a belief in some fundamental cleavage between truths which are analytic, or grounded in meanings independently of matters of fact, and truths which are synthetic, or grounded in fact. The other dogma is reductionism: the belief that each meaningful statement is equivalent to some logical construct upon terms which refer to immediate experience. (Quine 1951, 20)

“Both dogmas,” says Quine, “are ill-founded.”

The first dogma with which Quine is concerned is that there is an important distinction to be made between analytic and synthetic claims. Traditionally, the notions of analytic truth, a priori truth, and necessary truth have been closely linked to one another, forming a conceptual network that stands over against the supposedly contradictory network of a posteriori, contingent, and synthetic truths. Each of these categories will be explained briefly prior to addressing Quine’s critique of this “dogma” (for a more extensive treatment see the article on A Priori and A Posteriori).

An a priori truth is a proposition that can be known to be true by intuition or pure reason, without making empirical observations. For instance, neither mathematical truths such as 2+2=4, nor logical truths such as If ((a=b) &(b=c)) then (a=c), nor semantic truths such as All bachelors are unmarried men, depend upon the realization of any corresponding, worldly state of affairs, either in order to be true or to be known. A posteriori truths, on the other hand, are truths grounded in or at least known only by experience, including both mundane truths such as The cat is on the mat and scientific truths such as Bodies in free-fall accelerate at 9.8 m/s².

Many (if not all) a priori truths seem to be necessary—that is, they could not have been otherwise. On the other hand, many (if not all) a posteriori truths seem to be contingent—that is, that they could have been otherwise: the cat might not have been on the mat, and, for all we know, the rate of acceleration for bodies in freefall might have been different than what it is.

Finally, the necessity and a prioricity of such truths seem to be linked to their analyticity. A proposition is analytically true if the meanings of its terms require it to be true. For example, the proposition “All bachelors are men” is analytically true, because “man” is connected to “bachelor” in virtue of its meaning—a fact recognized by analyzing “bachelor” so as to see that it means “unmarried man”. On the other hand, “All bachelors have left the room” is not analytically true. It is called a synthetic proposition or truth, because it involves terms or concepts that are not connected analytically by their individual meanings, but only insofar as they are synthesized (brought together) in the proposition itself. Such truths are usually, and perhaps always, a posteriori and contingent.

Historically, philosophers have tended to try to explain necessity, a prioricity and analyticity by appealing to abstract objects such as Plato’s Forms or Aristotle’s essences. Such entities purportedly transcend the realm of time, space, and/or the senses, and hence the realm of “nature” as defined by science—at least as this was understood by the scientific naturalism of the late nineteenth and early twentieth centuries. Consequently, devotees of scientific naturalism required an alternative account of necessity, a priority, and analyticity; and here analytic philosophy’s linguistic turn seemed to offer a way forward.

For obvious reasons, and as the above quotation from Quine hints, analytic truths traditionally have been characterized as “true in virtue of meaning.” However, historically, “meaning” has been cashed out in different ways: in terms of abstract, Ideal entities (Plato, Aristotle, Husserl), and in terms of concepts (Locke, Hume), and in terms of language (construed as a system of concrete, sensible symbols with conventionally approved uses). In the context of analytic philosophy’s “linguistic turn,” it was all too easy to take the latter approach, and hence to treat analyticity as deriving from some linguistic phenomenon such as synonymy or the interchangeability of terms.

Such a view was highly amenable to the scientistic, naturalistic, and empiricistic leanings of many early analysts, and especially to the logical positivists. On the assumptions that meaning is fundamentally linguistic and that language is a conventional symbol-system in which the symbols are assigned meanings by fiat, one can explain synonymy without referring to anything beyond the realm of time, space and the senses. If one can then explain analyticity in terms of synonymy, and explain both necessity and a prioricity in terms of analyticity, then one will have theories of analytic, necessary, and a priori truths consistent with scientific naturalism.

Given Quine’s own commitment to scientific naturalism, one might have expected him to join the logical positivists and others in embracing this model and then striving for a workable version of it. However, Quine proposed a more radical solution to the scientific naturalist’s problem with necessity, a prioricity, and analyticity: namely, he proposed to reject the distinctions between analytic and synthetic, a priori and a posteriori, necessary and contingent.

He begins undermining the notion that synonymy-relations are established by fiat or “stipulative definition.” On the naturalistic view of language and meaning, all meanings and synonymy relations would have to have been established by some person or people making stipulative definitions at some particular place and time. For instance, someone would have had to have said, at some point in history, “henceforth, the symbol ‘bachelor’ shall be interchangeable with the symbol ‘unmarried man’.” However, Quine asks rhetorically, “who defined it thus, or when?” (Quine 1951, 24). The point is that we have no evidence of this ever having happened. Thus, at the very least, the naturalistic account of meaning/synonymy is an unverifiable theory of the sort the positivists wanted to avoid. Moreover, what empirical evidence we do have suggests that it is likely false, for, as Quine sees it, “definition—except in the extreme case of the explicitly conventional introduction of new notation—hinges on prior relationships of synonymy” (Quine 1951, 27). In cases where it appears that someone is making a stipulative definition—as in a dictionary, for example—Quine explains that, far from establishing synonymy, the stipulator is either describing or making use of synonymy relations already present in the language. After exploring several kinds of cases in which stipulative definitions seem to establish synonymy relations, he concludes that all but one—the banal act of coining an abbreviation—rely on pre-existing synonymy relations. The upshot is that stipulative definition cannot account for the breadth of cases in which synonymy is exemplified, and thus that it cannot be the general ground of either synonymy or analyticity.

With its foundation thus undermined, the naturalistic theory of analyticity, necessity and a prioricity collapses. However, rather than rejecting naturalism on account of its inability to explain these phenomena, Quine rejects the notion that naturalism needs to explain them on the ground that they are spurious categories. Prima facie, of course, there seems to be a distinction between the analytic and the synthetic, the a priori and the a posteriori, the necessary and the contingent. However, when we attempt to get a deeper understanding of these phenomena by defining them, we cannot do it. Quine explores several other ways of defining analyticity in addition to synonymy and stipulative definition, ultimately concluding that none work. To the contrary, analyticity, synonymy, necessity and related concepts seem to contribute to each other’s meaning/definition in a way that “is not flatly circular, but something like it. It has the form, figuratively speaking, of a closed curve in space” (Quine 1951, 29). Because none of them can be defined without invoking one of the others, no one of them can be eliminated by reducing it to one of the others. Rather than concluding that analyticity, a prioricity, necessity, and so forth are primitive phenomena, Quine takes their indefinability to indicate that there is no genuine distinction to be drawn between them and their traditional opposites.

This brings us to the second dogma. When Quine criticizes “reductionism,” he has principally in mind the logical positivists’ tendency to pursue the reductionist project as if every and any scientific statement, considered in isolation, could be reduced to/analyzed into a small set of observational statements related to it in such a way that they counted uniquely as that claim’s verification and meaning. Over against this “atomistic” or “isolationist” or “local” conception of verification/reductive analysis, Quine argued that scientific claims have predictive power, and hence verifiability or falsifiability, and hence also meaning, only as parts of large networks of claims that together form far-reaching theories that might be called “worldviews.” For this reason, one can never verify or falsify an isolated scientific claim; rather, verification and falsification—and hence also meaning—are holistic. Observations (and observation sentences) that may seem to verify a lone claim actually make a partial contribution to the verification of the total theoretical network to which it belongs.

As the language here suggests, viewed holistically, verification is never absolute. There is no manageable set of observations that will verify a total theory or any of its constitutive claims once and for all. By the same token, observations (and observation sentences) that may seem to falsify a lone claim do not decisively falsify either it or the theory to which it belongs. Rather, such observations require only that some adjustment be made to the theory. Perhaps one of its constitutive claims must be rejected, but not necessarily the one that initially seemed to be falsified. On Quine’s view, any constitutive claim can be saved by making adjustments elsewhere in the theory-network.

This holistic view of meaning and verification reinforces Quine’s rejection of the analytic/synthetic distinction and its fellows. Holism in these areas implies that no claim in one’s total theory is immune from revision or rejection in light of observational evidence. This means that even claims traditionally thought to be necessary and/or analytic, such as those of mathematics and logic, can be revised or rejected in order to preserve other claims to which one is more deeply committed.

Quine’s assault on the analytic/synthetic distinction undermines not merely the positivists’ reductionist project, but also the general practice of analysis which, from the beginning, had been understood to involve the transformation of a sentence into another sentence semantically equivalent (synonymous) but grammatically different. At the same time, Quine’s holism about the meaning of scientific claims and their verification generalizes to become a theory of meaning holism that applies to all meaningful claims whatsoever. However, following Moore’s practice, the analytic method was usually applied to claims in isolation, apart from considerations of their connection to other claims that together might constitute a philosophical “worldview.” Quinean meaning holism undermines this aspect of analysis just as much as it does the logical positivists “isolationist” view of verification.

4. The Later Wittgenstein and Ordinary-Language Philosophy

a. Ordinary-Language Philosophy

Thanks to G.E. Moore, ordinary-language analysis had had a place in the analytic movement from the very beginning. Because of the perceived superiority of ideal-language analysis, however, it dropped almost completely out of sight for several decades. In the 1930s, ordinary-language analysis began to make a comeback thanks mainly to Wittgenstein—whose views had undergone radical changes during the 1920s—but also to a number of other talented philosophers including John Wisdom, John Austin (not to be confused with the nineteenth-century John Austin who invented legal positivism), Gilbert Ryle, Peter Strawson and Paul Grice. Despite differences in their reasons for adopting the ordinary-language approach as well as their respective manners of employing it, these figures’ common focus on ordinary language was a substantial point of unity over against the initially dominant ideal-language approach.

Ordinary-language philosophy became dominant in analytic philosophy only after World War II—hence the dates for the ordinary-language era given in the Introduction are 1945-1965. Indeed, with the exception of several articles by Ryle, the most important texts of the ordinary-language camp were published in 1949 and later—in some cases not until much later, when the linguistic approach to philosophy in all its forms was already on its way out.

Ordinary-language philosophy is sometimes called “Oxford philosophy.” This is because Ryle, Austin, Strawson and Grice were all Oxford dons. They were the most important representatives of the ordinary-language camp after Wittgenstein (who was at Cambridge). After Wittgenstein died in the early years of the ordinary-language era, they lived to promote it through its heyday.

Despite the strong connection to Oxford, Wittgenstein is usually taken to be the most important of the ordinary-language philosophers. For this reason, we will focus only on his later views in giving a more detailed example of ordinary language philosophy.

b. The Later Wittgenstein

While logical positivism was busy crumbling under the weight of self-referential incoherence, a larger problem was brewing for ideal-language philosophy in general. After publishing the Tractatus, Wittgenstein retired from philosophy and went to teach grade-school in the Austrian countryside. Why wouldn’t he leave academia—after all, he believed he had already lain to rest all the traditional problems of philosophy!

During his time away from the academy, Wittgenstein had occasion to rethink his views about language. He concluded that, far from being a truth-functional calculus, language has no universally correct structure—that is, there is no such thing as an ideal language. Instead, each language-system—be it a full-fledged language, a dialect, or a specialized technical language used by some body of experts—is like a game that functions according to its own rules.

These rules are not of the sort found in grammar books—those are just attempts to describe rules already found in the practices of some linguistic community. Real linguistic rules, according to the later Wittgenstein, cannot be stated, but are rather shown in the complex intertwining of linguistic and non-linguistic practices that make up the “form of life” of any linguistic community. Language is, for the later Wittgenstein, an intrinsically social phenomenon, and its correct modes are as diverse as the many successful modes of corporate human life. Consequently, it cannot be studied in the abstract, apart from its many particular embodiments in human communities.

In contrast with his views in the Tractatus, the later Wittgenstein no longer believed that meaning is a picturing-relation grounded in the correspondence relationships between linguistic atoms and metaphysical atoms. Instead, language systems, or language games, are unanalyzable wholes whose parts (utterances sanctioned by the rules of the language) have meaning in virtue of having a role to play—a use—within the total form of life of a linguistic community. Thus it is often said that for the latter Wittgenstein meaning is use. On this view, the parts of a language need not refer or correspond to anything at all—they only have to play a role in a form of life.

It is important to note that even in his later thought, Wittgenstein retained the view that traditional philosophical problems arise from linguistic error, and that true philosophy is about analyzing language so as to grasp the limits of meaning and see that error for what it is—a headlong tumble into confusion or meaninglessness. However, his new understanding of language required a new understanding of analysis. No longer could it be the transformation of some ordinary language statement into the symbolic notation of formal logic purportedly showing its true form. Instead, it is a matter of looking at how language is ordinarily used and seeing that traditional philosophical problems arise only as we depart from that use.

“A philosophical problem,” says Wittgenstein, “has the form: ‘I don’t know my way about’” (Wittgenstein 1953, ¶123), that is, I don’t know how to speak properly about this, to ask a question about this, to give an answer to that question. If I were to transcend the rules of my language and say something anyhow, what I say would be meaningless nonsense. Such are the utterances of traditional, metaphysical philosophy. Consequently, philosophical problems are to be solved, or rather dissolved,

by looking into the workings of our language, and that in such a way as to make us recognize its workings: … The problems are solved, not by giving new information, but by arranging what we have always known. (Wittgenstein 1953, ¶ 109)

And “what we have always known” is the rules of our language. “The work of the philosopher,” he says, “consists in assembling reminders for a particular purpose” (Wittgenstein 1953, ¶ 127). These reminders take the form of examples of how the parts of language are ordinarily used in the language game out of which the philosoher has tried to step. Their purpose is to coax the philosopher away from the misuse of language essential to the pursuit of traditional philosophical questions. Thus the true philosophy becomes a kind of therapy aimed at curing a lingusitic disease that cripples one’s ability to fully engage in the form of life of one’s linguistic community. True philsophy, Wittgenstein says, “is a battle against the bewitchment of our intelligence by means of language” (Wittgenstein 1953, ¶ 109). The true philosopher’s weapon in this battle is “to bring words back from their metaphysical to their everyday use” (Wittgenstein 1953, ¶ 116), so that “the results of philosophy are the uncovering of one or another piece of plain nonsense and of bumps that the understanding has gotten by running its head up against the limits of language” (Wittgenstein 1953, ¶ 119).

Though Wittgenstein developed these new views much earlier (mainly in the 1920s and 30s), they were not officially published until 1953, in the posthumous Philosophical Investigations. Prior to this, Wittgenstein’s new views were spread largely by word of mouth among his students and other interested persons.

5. The 1960s and After: The Era of Eclecticism

a. The Demise of Linguistic Philosophy

By the mid-1960s the era of linguistic philosophy was coming to a close. The causes of its demise are variegated. For one thing, it was by this time apparent that there were deep divisions within the analytic movement, especially between the ordinary-language and ideal-language camps, over the nature of language and meaning on the one hand, and over how to do philosophy on the other. Up to this point, the core of analytic philosophy had been the view that philosophical problems are linguistic illusions generated by violating the boundaries of meaning, and that they were to be solved by clearly marking those boundaries and then staying within them. It was now becoming clear, however, that this was no easy task. Far from being the transparent phenomenon that the early analysts had taken it to be, linguistic meaning was turning out to be a very puzzling phenomenon, itself in need of deep, philosophical treatment.

Indeed, it was becoming clear that many who had held the core analytic view about the nature of philosophy had relied upon different theories of meaning sometimes implicit, never sufficiently clear, and frequently implausible. The internal failure of logical positivism combined with the external criticisms of Wittgenstein and Quine contributed to the demise of the ideal-language approach. On the other hand, many, including Bertrand Russell, saw the ordinary-language approach as falling far short of serious, philosophical work. For this and other reasons, the ordinary-language approach also drew fire from outside the analytic movement, in the form of Ernest Gellner’s Words and Things (1959) and W.C.K. Mundle’s Critique of Linguistic Philosophy (1970). The former especially had a large, international impact, thereby contributing to what T. P. Uschanov has called “the strange death of ordinary language philosophy.”

The waning of linguistic philosophy signaled also the waning of attempts to specify the proper philosophical method, or even just the method distinctive of analytic philosophy. Quine’s take on the matter—that philosophy is continuous with science in its aims and methods, differing only in the generality of its questions—proved influential and achieved a certain level of dominance for a time, but not to the extent that the linguistic conception of philosophy had during its sixty-year run. Alternatives tied less tightly to the empirical sciences soon emerged, with the result that philosophical practice in contemporary analytic philosophy is now quite eclectic. In some circles, the application of formal techniques is still regarded as central to philosophical practice, though this is now more likely to be regarded as a means of achieving clarity about our concepts than as a way of analyzing language. In other circles meticulous expression in ordinary language is seen to provide a sufficient level of clarity.

Partly because of Quine’s view of philosophy as continuous with science (which, of course, is divided into specializations), and partly because analytic philosophy had always been given to dealing with narrowly-defined questions in isolation from others, post-linguistic analytic philosophy partitioned itself into an ever-increasing number of specialized sub-fields. What had been linguistic philosophy metamorphosed into what we now know as the philosophy of language. Epistemology, the philosophy of mind, the philosophy of science, ethics and meta-ethics, and even metaphysics emerged or re-emerged as areas of inquiry not indifferent to linguistic concerns, but not themselves intrinsically linguistic. Over time, the list has expanded to include aesthetics, social and political philosophy, feminist philosophy, the philosophy of religion, philosophy of law, cognitive science, and the history of philosophy.

On account of its eclecticism, contemporary analytic philosophy defies summary or general description. By the same token, it encompasses far too much to discuss in any detail here. However, two developments in post-linguistic analytic philosophy require special mention.

b. The Renaissance in Metaphysics

Metaphysics has undergone a certain sort of renaissance in post-linguistic analytic philosophy. Although contemporary analytic philosophy does not readily countenance traditional system-building metaphysics (at least as a respected professional activity), it has embraced the piecemeal pursuit of metaphysical questions so wholeheartedly that metaphysics is now seen as one of its three most important sub-disciplines. (The other two are epistemology and the philosophy of language; all three are frequently referred to as “core” analytic areas or sub-disciplines.) This is noteworthy given analytic philosophy’s traditional anti-metaphysical orientation.

The return of metaphysics is due mainly to the collapse of those theories of meaning which originally had banned it as meaningless, but later developments in the philosophy of language also played a role. In the 1960s, the ordinary-language philosopher Peter Strawson began advocating for what he called “descriptive metaphysics,” a matter of looking to the structure and content of natural languages to illuminate the contours of different metaphysical worldviews or “conceptual schemes.” At the same time, and despite his naturalism and scientism which pitted him against speculative metaphysics, Quine’s holistic views about meaning and verification opened the door to speculative metaphysics by showing that theory cannot be reduced to observation even in the sciences. In the 1960s and 70s, the attempts of Donald Davidson and others to construct a formal theory of meaning based on Alfred Tarski’s formal definition of truth eventually led to the development of possible worlds semantics by David Lewis. Consistent with the Quinean insight that meaning is connected to holistic worldviews or, in more metaphysical terms, world-states, possible worlds semantics defines important logical concepts such as validity, soundness and completeness, as well as concepts that earlier logics were incapable of handling—such as possibility and necessity—in terms of total descriptions of a way that some worlds or all worlds might be/have been. For example, proposition p is necessary, if p is true in all possible worlds. Thus, despite its formalism, possible world semantics approximates some aspects of traditional metaphysics that earlier analytic philosophy eschewed.

With the advent of possible worlds semantics, attention shifted from the notion of meaning to that of reference. The latter has to do explicitly with the language-world connection, and so has an overtly metaphysical aspect. In the 1970s, direct reference theories came to dominate the philosophy of language. Developed independently by Saul Kripke and Ruth Barcan Marcus, a direct reference theory claims that some words—particularly proper names—have no meaning, but simply serve as “tags” (Marcus’ term) or “rigid designators” (Kripke’s term) for the things they name. Tagging or rigid designation is usually spelled-out in terms of possible worlds: it is a relation between name and thing such that it holds in all possible worlds. This then provides a linguistic analog of a metaphysical theory of identity the likes of which one finds in traditional “substance” metaphysics such as that of Aristotle. With the restrictions characteristic of earlier analytic philosophy removed, these positions in the philosophy of language made for an easy transition into metaphysics proper.

c. The Renaissance in History

Because analytic philosophy initially saw itself as superseding traditional philosophy, its tendency throughout much of the twentieth century was to disregard the history of philosophy. It is even reported that a sign reading “just say no to the history of ideas” once hung on a door in the Philosophy building at Princeton University (Grafton 2004, 2). Though earlier analytic philosophers would sometimes address the views of a philosopher from previous centuries, they frequently failed to combine philosophical acumen with historical care, thereby falling into faulty, anachronistic interpretations of earlier philosophers.

Beginning in the 1970s, some in the analytic context began to rebel against this anti-historical attitude. The following remembrance by Daniel Garber describes well the emerging historical consciousness in the analytic context (though this was not then and is not now so widespread as to count as characteristic of analytic philosophy itself):

What my generation of historians of philosophy was reacting against was a bundle of practices that characterized the writing of the history of philosophy in the period: the tendency to substitute rational reconstructions of a philosopher’s views for the views themselves; the tendency to focus on an extremely narrow group of figures (Descartes, Spinoza, and Leibniz, Locke, Berkeley and Hume in my period); within that very narrow canon the tendency to focus on just a few works at the exclusion of others, those that best fit with our current conception of the subject of philosophy; the tendency to work exclusively from translations and to ignore secondary work that was not originally written in English; the tendency to treat the philosophical positions as if they were those presented by contemporaries, and on and on and on. (Garber 2004, 2)

Over against this “bundle of practices,” the historical movement began to interpret the more well-known problems and views of historical figures in the context of, first, the wholes of their respective bodies of work, second, their respective intellectual contexts, noting how their work related to that of the preceding generation of thinkers, and, third, the broader social environment in which they lived and thought and wrote.

Eventually, this new historical approach was adopted by philosopher-scholars interested in the history of analytic philosophy itself. As a result, the last two decades have seen the emergence of the history (or historiography) of analytic philosophy as an increasingly important sub-discipline within analytic philosophy itself. Major figures in this field include Tom Baldwin, Hans Sluga, Nicholas Griffin, Peter Hacker, Ray Monk, Peter Hylton, Hans-Johann Glock and Michael Beaney, among a good many others. The surge of interest in the history of analytic philosophy has even drawn efforts from philosophers better known for work in “core” areas of analytic philosophy, such as Michael Dummett and Scott Soames.

Some of these authors are responsible for discovering or re-discovering the fact that neither Moore nor Russell conceived of themselves as linguistic philosophers. Others have been involved in the debate over Frege mentioned in Section 2c. All this has served to undermine received views and to open a debate concerning the true nature of analytic philosophy and the full scope of its history. (For more on this, see Preston 2004, 2005a-b).

6. References and Further Reading

The main divisions of this bibliography correspond to the main divisions of the article, which in turn correspond to the main historical phases of analytic philosophy. In addition, there is at the end a section on anthologies, collections and reference works that do not fit nicely under the other headings.

a. The Revolution of Moore and Russell: Cambridge Realism and The Linguistic Turn

Primary Sources

Moore, G. E. 1899: “The Nature of Judgment,” Mind 8, 176-93. Reprinted in Moore 1993, 1-19.
Moore, G. E. 1903a: Principia Ethica, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Moore, G. E. 1903b: “The Refutation of Idealism” Mind 12, 433-53. Reprinted in Moore 1993, 23-44.
Moore, G. E. 1925: “A Defense of Common Sense” in J. H. Muirhead ed., Contemporary British Philosophy, London: Allen and Unwin, 193-223. Reprinted in Moore 1959, 126-148, and Moore 1993, 106-33.
Moore, G. E. 1939: “Proof of an External World,” Proceedings of the British Academy 25, 273-300. Reprinted in Moore 1993, 147-70.
Moore, G. E. 1942a: “An Autobiography,” in Schilpp ed., 1942, 3-39.
Moore, G. E. 1942b: “A Reply to My Critics,” in Schilpp ed., 1942, 535-677.
Moore, G. E. 1959: Philosophical Papers, London: George Allen and Unwin.
Moore, G. E. 1993: G.E. Moore: Selected Writings, ed. Thomas Baldwin, London: Routledge.
Russell, Bertrand. 1959: My Philosophical Development, London: George Allen and Unwin; New York: Simon and Schuster.

Secondary Sources

Ayer, A.J. (ed ) 1971: Russell and Moore: The Analytical Heritage, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
Baldwin, T. 1990: G. E. Moore, London: Routledge.
Baldwin, T. 1991: “The Identity Theory of Truth,” Mind, New Series, Vol. 100, No. 1, 35-52.
Bell, David. 1999: “The Revolution of Moore and Russell: A Very British Coup?” in Anthony O’Hear (ed.), German Philosophy Since Kant, Cambridge and New York: Cambridge University Press.
Griffin, Nicholas. 1991: Russell’s Idealist Apprenticeship, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
Hylton, Peter. 1990: Russell, Idealism, and the Emergence of Analytic Philosophy, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
Schilpp, P.A., ed. 1942: The Philosophy of G.E. Moore, Library of Living Philosophers Vol. 4, La Salle: Open Court.

b. Russell and the Early Wittgenstein: Ideal Language and Logical Atomism

Primary Sources

Frege, Gottlob. 1879: Concept Script, a formal language of pure thought modeled upon that of arithmetic, tr. by S. Bauer-Mengelberg, in J. van Heijenoort (ed.), From Frege to Gödel: A Source Book in Mathematical Logic, 1879-1931, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1967.
Frege, Gottlob. 1892: “On Sense and Reference” tr. by M. Black, in Translations from the Philosophical Writings of Gottlob Frege, P. Geach and M. Black (eds.), Oxford: Blackwell, 3rd ed., 1980.
Russell, Bertrand. 1905: “On Denoting,” Mind 14: 479-93.
Russell, Bertrand. 1908: “Mathematical Logic as Based on the Theory of Types,” American Journal of Mathematics, 30, 222-262. Reprinted in Russell 1956, 59-102.
Russell, Bertrand. 1914: “On Scientific Method in Philosophy,” in Russell 1918, 97-124.
Russell, Bertrand. 1918-19: “The Philosophy of Logical Atomism,” The Monist 28:495-527 and 29:33-63, 190-222, 344-80; reprinted La Salle, Illinois: Open Court, 1985.
Russell, Bertrand. 1918: Mysticism and Logic: and Other Essays, New York: Longmans, Green and Co.
Russell, Bertrand. 1944a: “My Mental Development,” in Schilpp, ed. 1944, 3-20.
Russell, Bertrand. 1944b: “Reply to Criticisms,” in Schilpp, ed. 1944, 681-741.
Russell, Bertrand. 1946: “The Philosophy of Logical Analysis,” from A History of Western Philosophy, London: Allen and Unwin; New York: Simon and Schuster, 1946; reprinted in Dennon and Egner, eds., 1961, pp. 301-307.
Russell, Bertrand. 1950: “Is Mathematics Purely Linguistic?,” in Russell 1973, pp. 295-306.
Russell, Bertrand. 1956: Logic and Knowledge, Robert Marsh, ed., London: Unwin Hyman Ltd.
Russell, Bertrand. 1959: My Philosophical Development, London: Unwin.
Russell, Bertrand. 1973: Essays in Analysis, Douglas lackey, ed., London: George Allen and Unwin Ltd.
Russell, Bertrand, and Whitehead, Alfred North. 1910-1913: Principia Mathematica 3 vols. London: Cambridge University Press. Second edition 1925.
Wittgenstein, Ludwig. 1922: Tractatus Logico-Philosophicus, tr. C.K. Ogden. London: Routledge & Kegan Paul.

Secondary Sources

Kenny, Anthony. 2000: Frege: An Introduction to the Founder of Modern Analytic Philosophy, Blackwell Publishers.
Baker, G .P. and Hacker, P.M.S. 1983: “Dummett’s Frege or Through a Looking-Glass Darkly,” Mind, 92, pp. 239-246.
Baker, G .P. and Hacker, P.M.S. 1984: Frege: Logical Excavations, Oxford: Blackwell.
Baker, G .P. and Hacker, P.M.S. 1987: “Dummett’s Dig: Looking-Glass Archaeology,” Philosophical Quarterly, 37, pp. 86-99.
Baker, G .P. and Hacker, P.M.S. 1989: “The Last Ditch,” Philosophical Quarterly, 39, pp. 471-477.
Dummett, Michael. 1991: Frege: Philosophy of Mathematics, London: Duckworth.
Monk, Ray and Palmer, Anthony (eds.). 1996: Bertrand Russell and the Origins of Analytical Philosophy, Bristol: Thoemmes Press.
Reck, Erich (ed.). 2001: From Frege to Wittgenstein: Perspectives on Early analytic philosophy, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Pears, D.F. 1967: Bertrand Russell and the British Tradition in Philosophy, London: Collins.
Schilpp, P.A. 1944: The Philosophy of Bertrand Russell, Library of Living Philosophers Vol. 5, La Salle: Open Court.
Schrenmann, R. (ed.) 1967: Bertrand Russell: Philosopher of the Century, London: Allen and Unwin.
Tait, William (ed). 1997: Early Analytic Philosophy: Frege, Russell, Wittgenstein; Essays in Honor of Leonard Linsky, Chicago: Open Court.

c. Logical Positivism, the Vienna Circle, and Quine

Primary Sources

Ayer, A.J. 1936: Language, Truth and Logic, London: Gollantz; second edition 1946; reprinted New York: Dover, 1952.
Carnap, Rudolf. 1928: The Logical Structure of the World. English trans. published by Berkeley: University of California Press, 1969.
Carnap, Rudolf. 1934: “On the Character of Philosophical Problems,” tr. W.M. Malisoff, in Rorty (ed.) 1967, 54-62.
Hempel, Carl. 1950: “Problems and Changes in the Empiricist Criterion of Meaning.” Revue Internationale de Philosophie 4:41-63; reprinted in Ayer (ed.) 1959.
Quine, W. V. “Truth by Convention.” In O.H. Lee (ed.), Philosophical Essays for A.N. Whitehead, New York: Longmans, 1936; reprinted in Ways of Paradox: New York: Random House, 1966.
Quine, W. V. 1951: “Two Dogmas of Empiricism.” Philosophical Review 60(1951):20-43.
Quine, W. V. Word and Object. Cambridge MA: MIT Press, 1960.
Quine, W. V. Ontological Relativity and Other Essays. New York: Columbia University Press, 1969.

Secondary Sources

Ayer, A.J. (ed ) 1959: Logical Positivism, Westport: Greenwood Press, 1959.
Schilpp, P.A. 1963: The Philosophy of Rudolf Carnap, Library of Living Philosophers, Vol. 11, La Salle: Open Court.
Schilpp, P.A. The Philosophy of W.V. Quine, Library of Living Philosophers, Vol. 18, La Salle: Open Court.
Schilpp, P.A. 1992: The Philosophy of A. J. Ayer, Library of Living Philosophers, Vol. 21, La Salle: Open Court.
Sarkar, Sahotra (ed.) 1996: Science and Philosophy in the Twentieth Century: Basic Works of Logical Empiricism, 6 vols., New York & London: Garland Publishing.

d. The Later Wittgenstein, et al.: Ordinary-Language Philosophy

Primary Sources

Austin, J.L. 1962: How to Do Things with Words, New York: Oxford University Press.
Austin, J.L. 1962: Sense and Sensibilia, London: Oxford University Press.
Grice, Paul. 1989: Studies in the Way of Words, Cambridge MA: Harvard University Press.
Ryle, Gilbert. 1949: The Concept of Mind, New York: Barnes and Noble.
Ryle, Gilbert. 1953: Dilemmas, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Strawson, Peter. 1950: “On Referring” Mind, 59: 320-344.
Strawson, Peter and Grice, H. P. 1956: “In Defense of a Dogma,” Philosophical Review, 65: 141-58; reprinted in Grice 1989.
Wisdom, John. 1931: Interpretation and Analysis in Relation to Bentham’s Theory of Definition,London: Kegan, Paul, Trench, Trubner &Co.
Wisdom, John. 1952: Other Minds, Oxford: Blackwell.
Wittgenstein, Ludwig. 1953: Philosophical Investigations, tr. G.E.M. Anscombe. Oxford: Blackwell.

Secondary Sources

Canfield, J.V. (ed) 1986: The Philosophy of Wittgenstein, New York and London: Garland Publishing, Inc.
Hacker, P.M.S. 1986: Insight and Illusion: Themes in the Philosophy of Wittgenstein, Oxford: Clarendon.
Kripke, Saul. 1982: Wittgenstein On Rules and Private Language, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
Urmson, J. O. 1956: Philosophical Analysis: Its Development Between the Two World Wars, London, Oxford, New York: Oxford University Press.

e. The 1960s and After: The Era of Eclecticism

Hacking, Ian, 1975: Why Does Language Matter to Philosophy?, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Kripke, Saul. 1980: Naming and Necessity Cambridge MA: Harvard University Press.
Mundle, C. W. K. 1970: A Critique of Linguistic Philosophy, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
Gellner, E. 1959: Words and Things: A Critical Account of Linguistic Philosophy and a Study in Ideology, London: Gollancz.

f. Critical and Historical Accounts of Analytic Philosophy

Ayer, A. J., et al. 1963: The Revolution in Philosophy, London: Macmillan & Co. Ltd.
Ayer, A.J. (ed ) 1982: Philosophy in the Twentieth Century, London: Weidenfield and Nicolson.
Beaney, Michael. 2003: “Analysis,” Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy, URL= < http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/analysis/>.
Biletzki and Matar (eds.). 1998: The Story of Analytic Philosophy: Plot and Heroes, London and New York: Routledge.
Capaldi, Nicholas. 2000: The Enlightenment Project in the Analytic Conversation, Dordrecht, Boston, London: Kluwer Academic Publishers.
Charlton, William. 1991: The Analytic Ambition: An Introduction to Philosophy, Oxford and Cambridge: Blackwell.
Clarke, D.S. 1997: Philosophy’s Second Revolution: Early and Recent Analytic Philosophy, La Salle: Open Court.
Coffa, J.A. 1991: The Semantic Tradition from Kant to Carnap, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Cohen, L. J. 1986: The Dialogue of Reason: An Analysis of Analytical Philosophy, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
Collingwood, R.G. An Essay on Philosophical Method
Corrado, Michael. 1975: The Analytic Tradition in Philosophy: Background and Issues, Chicago: American Library Association.
Dummett, Michael. 1993: Origins of Analytical Philosophy, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
Garber, Daniel. 2004: “Philosophy and the Scientific Revolution,” in Teaching New Histories of Philosophy, Princeton: Princeton University Center for Human Values.
Glock, Hans-Johann (ed.). 1997: The Rise of Analytic Philosophy, Oxford: Blackwell Publishers.
Grafton, Anthony. 2004: “A Note from Inside the Teapot,” in Teaching New Histories of Philosophy, Princeton: Princeton University Center for Human Values.
Hanna, Robert. 2001: Kant and the Foundations of Analytic Philosophy, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Mehta, Ved. 1961: Fly and the Fly Bottle: Encounters with British Intellectuals, New York: Columbia University Press.
Nagel, Ernest. 1936a-b: “Impressions and Appraisals of Analytic Philosophy in Europe,” The Journal of Philosophy vol. 33, no. 1, 5-24 and no. 2, 29-53.
Pap, Arthur. 1949: Elements of Analytic Philosophy. New York: Macmillan.
Preston, Aaron. 2004: “Prolegomena to Any Future History of Analytic Philosophy,” Metaphilosophy, vol. 35, no. 4, 445-465.
Preston, Aaron. 2005a: “Conformism in Analytic Philosophy: On Shaping Philosophical Boundaries and Prejudices,” The Monist, Volume 88, Number 2, April 2005.
Preston, Aaron. 2005b: “Implications of Recent Work on Analytic Philosophy,” The Bertrand Russell Society Quarterly, no. 127 (August 2005), 11-30.
Prosch, Harry. 1964: The Genesis of Twentieth Century Philosophy: The Evolution of Thought from Copernicus to the Present, Garden City: Doubleday and Co., Inc.
Soames, Scott. 2003. Philosophical Analysis in the Twentieth Century, 2 vols., Princeton: Princeton University Press.
Stroll, Avrum. 2000: Twentieth Century Analytic Philosophy, New York: Columbia University Press.
Warnock, G.J. 1958: English Philosophy Since 1900, London: Oxford University Press.

g. Anthologies and General Introductions

Ammerman, Robert (ed.). 1990: Classics of Analytic Philosophy, Indianapolis: Hackett.
Baillie, James (ed.). 2002: Contemporary Analytic Philosophy: Core Readings, 2nd edition, Prentice Hall.
Martinich, A. P. and Sosa, David (eds.). 2001a: Analytic Philosophy: An Anthology, Blackwell Publishers.
Martinich, A. P. and Sosa, David (eds.). 2001b: A Companion to Analytic Philosophy, Blackwell Publishers.
Rorty, Richard (ed.). 1992: The Linguistic Turn: Essays in Philosophical Method, Chicago and London: The University of Chicago Press.

Author Information

Aaron Preston
Email: Aaron.Preston@valpo.edu
Valparaiso University
U. S. A.

Consequentialism

Consequentialism is the view that morality is all about producing the right kinds of overall consequences. Here the phrase “overall consequences” of an action means everything the action brings about, including the action itself. For example, if you think that the whole point of morality is (a) to spread happiness and relieve suffering, or (b) to create as much freedom as possible in the world, or (c) to promote the survival of our species, then you accept consequentialism. Although those three views disagree about which kinds of consequences matter, they agree that consequences are all that matters. So, they agree that consequentialism is true. The utilitarianism of John Stuart Mill and Jeremy Bentham is a well known example of consequentialism. By contrast, the deontological theories of John Locke and Immanuel Kant are nonconsequentialist.

Consequentialism is controversial. Various nonconsequentialist views are that morality is all about doing one’s duty, respecting rights, obeying nature, obeying God, obeying one’s own heart, actualizing one’s own potential, being reasonable, respecting all people, or not interfering with others—no matter the consequences.

This article describes different versions of consequentialism. It also sketches several of the most popular reasons to believe consequentialism, along with objections to those reasons, and several of the most popular reasons to disbelieve it, along with objections to those reasons.

Basic Issues and Simple Versions
Two Simple Arguments for Consequentialism
1. Only Results Remain
2. Love
Arguments Against Consequentialism
Further Arguments for Consequentialism
References and Further Reading

1. Basic Issues and Simple Versions

a. Introduction to Plain Consequentialism

There is disagreement about how consequentialism can best be formulated as a precise theory, and so there are various versions of consequentialism. Almost all lack standard names, so the names used here are mostly invented here. Perhaps the most standard precise version of consequentialism is Plain Consequentialism.

Plain Consequentialism: Of all the things a person might do at any given moment, the morally right action is the one with the best overall consequences. (If there is no one best action because several actions are tied for best consequences, then of course any of those several actions would be right.)

Other versions of consequentialism may be generated by making small changes in this theory, as we shall see, so long as the new theory stays faithful to the broad idea that morality is all about producing the right kinds of overall consequences.

Consequentialism does not itself say what kinds of consequences are good. Hence people can agree on consequentialism while disagreeing about what kind of outcome is good or bad. If you happen to be in charge of setting speed limits, you might be thinking that a bad result is a death: the fewer deaths, the better. But the people who die in accidents were all going to die eventually anyway, so a fatal accident does not mean there are more deaths than there otherwise would have been. Perhaps, then, what counts as a good result is the amount of life that the action adds or subtracts in the world? That would explain why fatal accidents are bad, since an early death means less life. But if quantity of life were the only kind of good result, then a long happy life would be no better than a long unhappy life.

The most traditional view among Consequentialists is that the only kind of result that is good in itself is happiness. The picture is roughly as follows. Suppose you are on average just as happy as I am, but you live twice as long. Then you will have had twice as much happiness as I had. So the total happiness we had is three times the happiness I had. Or suppose you are on average twice as happy as I am, and we live equally long. Here too you end up having had twice as much happiness as I had, so the total happiness we had is three times the happiness I had. Or suppose you are unhappy instead: on average just as unhappy as I am happy and for the same amount of time. Unhappiness can be thought of as negative happiness, so that the total happiness we two have in this third case is zero. Now, to find the goodness of the consequences of an action, simply take the total amount of happiness in those consequences. The more happiness there is, the better. Note that if what matters is the total amount, then it does not matter whether the happiness belongs to you or your friend or a stranger—or even a dog, if dogs can have happiness. And it does not matter whether the happiness will happen today or next year. See Bentham (1789); Den Uyl & Machan (1983).

If we take the above view that the good is happiness, and plug it into Plain Consequentialism, we get the view that the right action is the one that causes the most happiness—more than would have been caused by any of the available alternative actions.

On this view, a problem with setting a very high speed limit is that it causes early deaths, which reduce the amount of life and thus reduce the amount of happiness there will be. But a problem with setting a very low speed limit is that driving very slowly takes up time. If people can get where they are going more quickly, they will probably use the time they saved to do things that will add happiness to their lives or the lives of others. Consequentialism suggests that to set a speed limit rightly, you must balance such considerations accurately.

b. What is a “Consequence”?

As mentioned above, in consequentialism the “consequences” of an action are everything the action brings about, including the action itself. In consequentialism, the “consequences” of an action include (a) the action itself, and (b) everything the action causes. What then, do these two kinds of consequence have in common, that makes them both “consequences”? If there is an answer, perhaps it is something like this: both A itself and the things A causes are things that happen if you do A rather than the alternatives to A.

Another important point about “consequences” is that the actual “consequences” of an action, beyond the action itself, need not be actual outcomes. (Before explaining this point, we should note that consequentialism on most versions is a theory about the moral quality of actions. And it is commonly thought that the main kinds of actions that can be morally right or wrong are intentional actions—things we do deliberately, not things like hiccups or small twitches. Hence in the context of consequentialism, perhaps “actions” should normally be understood to mean “intentional actions.”) Suppose I will bake a cake if you win a coin toss, and you are now deciding whether to toss the coin or just walk away. Eventually you decide to toss the coin, you win, and I bake the cake. Was the cake a consequence of your action of tossing the coin? Arguably it was not. For you could have tossed the coin in many slightly different ways, and in many slightly different positions. Your intentional action was to toss the coin, not to toss the coin in the precise manner and position in which you ended up tossing it. But it was the precise manner and position that made you win. Therefore, your intentional action of tossing did not make you win. (But see Tännsjö (1988), 41ff.) Hence, arguably, the consequence of your intentional action was a 50% chance of a cake—not a cake, not half a cake, but a 50% chance of a cake. Perhaps most consequences of most actions we decide on are like that: not actual outcomes, but only probabilities of outcomes.

The usual Consequentialist view is that a 50% chance of a certain good outcome is half as good as that good outcome itself, and a 10% chance is one tenth as good.

Hence it would be misleading to say that consequentialism is the view that morality is all about results. When your boss says she cares only about “results,” that commonly means she does not care whether your gamble had a 1% or a 99% chance of succeeding. She cares only about whether it actually succeeded—even though, as explained above, the success, when it happens, is arguably not a “consequence” of your intentional action at all.

c. Plain Scalar Consequentialism

Plain Consequentialism is a theory about which actions are right. Its standard is high. It says that among all the very many things we could do at any given time, only one or a very few of them are right. The implication is that the rest of them are wrong. So if your action does vastly more good than what most other people would do in similar circumstances, but you could have chosen an action that would have done even a little more, Plain Consequentialism says that what you did was morally wrong. Plain Scalar Consequentialism is different.

Plain Scalar Consequentialism: Of any two things a person might do at any given moment, one is better than another to the extent that its overall consequences are better than the other’s overall consequences.

That is, if A’s consequences are a little better than B’s, then A is morally a little better than B; and if A’s consequences are much better than C’s, then A is morally much better than C. This theory implies that the actions with the best consequences are morally best, but it does not say that if you do the second-best you are doing something morally wrong. It says nothing about right and wrong. See Singer (1977); Norcross (1997).

d. Expectable Consequentialism and Reasonable Consequentialism

Of course, we cannot know the overall consequences of our actions. For example, the setting of a speed limit will help some people and hurt others, but there is no way to know in advance who the people will be, what projects will be helped or hindered, and how the further effects of all these things will play out over the centuries. You cannot know all that before you act (or after).

Is that point an objection to consequentialism? On the one hand, one might think it is an objection, since we are responsible for doing what is morally right and so we must be able to know what is morally right. On the other hand, one might think it is impossible to know what is morally right; morality seems permanently controversial and mysterious. It is unclear, then, whether the standard to which we should hold theories of morality is that they must explain why morality is easy to know about or why morality is terribly hard to know about!

The fact that we do not know the overall consequences of our actions makes room for further versions of consequentialism. Suppose I donate $100 to Malaria Aid, but it turns out this group aids malaria and I have funded an outbreak. Now, Plain Consequentialism implies that what I did is morally wrong, and Plain Scalar Consequentialism implies that it is morally very bad. But you might think that whether my action was morally wrong depends on what consequences it would have been reasonable for me to expect, not on the actual consequences. If the evil group was so cleverly deceptive that even the Better Business Bureau’s web site said they do good work fighting malaria, then you may think the damage done by my money was not my fault. So you may prefer a different version of consequentialism.

Expectable Consequentialism: The morally right action is the action whose reasonably expectable consequences are best. (There can also be a scalar version of this view and of the others introduced below.)

Reasonable estimates of consequences seem to involve a different kind of probability from that discussed in 1.b above. For example, suppose there is a machine that tosses a fair coin with such precision that whenever you press the Toss button, the coin always comes up heads. Now, suppose that you do not happen to know whether this machine always yields heads or always tails. (Or perhaps you do not even know that it is a precision machine.) When you press Toss, your action will have heads as a consequence, but you do not know that. So far as you can tell, heads and tails are equally likely, even if objectively there is a 100% chance of heads. This point can be expressed by saying that there is a 50% epistemic probability of heads, or that the reasonably expectable consequences of pushing the Toss button include a 50% epistemic chance of heads. For purposes of Expectable Consequentialism, a 50% epistemic chance of a good result is half as good as a 100% probability of that same result.

But Expectable Consequentialism has a strange implication. Suppose someone from Tuberculosis Aid comes to my door, says only, “Would you give to Tuberculosis Aid?” and hands me a pamphlet, which explains their evil plans on page 2. The reasonable way to estimate consequences would involve at least glancing through the pamphlet, but I am not interested. I simply assume that this group fights tuberculosis, and I do not look at the pamphlet because I do not care. I do not donate. Thus, without reasonably thinking about my choice, I have done what it would have been reasonable to estimate would have the best results. So Expectable Consequentialism says my thoughtless selfish action was morally right. If you do not want to praise my conduct, you might prefer a new version of consequentialism:

Reasonable Consequentialism: An action is morally right if and only if it has the best reasonably expected consequences.

Reasonable Consequentialism says that for an action of mine to be right, I must actually come to a reasonable conclusion beforehand about the consequences. Expectable Consequentialism says that an action can be right even if I do not think reasonably about it at all, so long as it is the action I would have estimated to have the best consequences if I had done a reasonable job of making an estimate. See Smart (1961).

e. Dual Consequentialism

Reasonable Consequentialism may be too simple. There was something right about my not donating. You might want to say that I fortunately did the right thing, but that my action was morally wrong. For another example, suppose I am sick and you are a doctor. You do a thorough and brilliant job of diagnosis and end up giving me the pill any responsible doctor would have to choose for the symptoms I display. But the pill turns out to harm me, because I have a rare and previously unknown virus. Now in one sense your prescription was wrong, but in another sense it was morally right. Dual Consequentialism can say both of those things. See Sidgwick (1907); Brink (1986).

Dual Consequentialism: The word “right” is ambiguous. It has a moral sense and an objective sense. (i) The objectively right action is the action with the best consequences, and (ii) the morally right action is any action with the best reasonably expected consequences.

f. Rule Consequentialism

If most people who live along a short river toss their garbage in the river, so that it is always full of garbage, then your tossing your own garbage in the river makes no difference to the river, and it saves the inconvenience of driving a few miles to the dump. So consequentialism would seem to support your tossing your garbage in the river. But if everyone hauled their garbage a few miles to the dump instead, in a year or two everyone would have a nice river, which is much more valuable to each person than the minor convenience of not having to haul one’s garbage to the dump. In this case, if each person follows consequentialism, the results are predictably worse than if everyone does something else instead. Thus consequentialism seems to defeat its own purpose.

Hence another kind of theory has been suggested, which might or might not be regarded as a version of consequentialism.

Rule Consequentialism: An action is morally right if and only if it does not violate the set of rules of behavior whose general acceptance in the community would have the best consequences—that is, at least as good as any rival set of rules or no rules at all.

(The name ‘Rule Consequentialism’ is an established term for many variant theories similar to the above). On this theory, an action is not right or wrong because of its own consequences; rather, it is right or wrong depending on whether it violates the collective rules that would have the best consequences. According to Rule Consequentialism, the right thing for each person in the community near the river to do is to follow the rule, “Throw garbage in the dump, not in the river.” Even if nobody else is going to the dump, and your going to the dump causes only inconvenience and no benefit, Rule Consequentialism says to take your garbage to the dump because that is what the best set of community rules would require.

Rule Consequentialism in one or another form has received a great deal of discussion. But since many people regard it as not quite in the spirit of consequentialism and many of the issues surrounding Rule Consequentialism are unique to it, we shall say little more about it here. See Brandt (1979); Hooker et al (2000).

There are more versions of consequentialism than are presented above. See Adams (1976); Railton (1988); Goodin (1995); Mulgan (1997); Murphy (1997). Some others are presented below, and anyone can invent new ones by following the instructions given in section 1a.

2. Two Simple Arguments for Consequentialism

In Section 2 we shall look at two initial reasons to think consequentialism is true and some worries about those reasons. In Section 3 we shall discuss reasons to think consequentialism is false and some worries about those reasons. In Section 4 we shall return to more complex reasons to think consequentialism is true and some worries about those reasons.

a. Only Results Remain

Actions are transient things, soon gone forever. Hence, one might think, in the long run only the results remain, so the only thing that really matters about an action is its results. So consequentialism must be true.

But this reason for favoring consequentialism seems confused. For one thing, consequentialism holds that actions do matter, because they are among their own consequences. More importantly, in the long run no result remains, or at least no earthly result. Pleasures pass by as quickly as actions. People too pass away, and planets evaporate. If only permanent things mattered, then your happiness and misery in this life would not matter at all; but surely they do matter.

b. Love

Arguably consequentialism is implicit in the very familiar conception of morality, shared by many cultures and traditions, which holds that moral perfection means loving all people, loving others as we love ourselves. For what is meant by “love” here? Forming many romantic attachments hardly seems like the path toward perfection; nor perhaps does the widespread spiritual exercise of focusing on wishing people well without actually helping them. If there is truth in the saying that we should “love all people,” perhaps it is simply that we should actively do what is good for people and not bad for them, as much as possible. If we try to produce the greatest total benefit, then we are loving “all people” in the sense that we are being impartial, caring for people in general, promoting each person’s well-being insofar as that is at stake in our actions and insofar as our helping one does not hurt others more.

A similar line of thought starts from the idea that morality is at bottom two things. First, abstractly, to be moral is to do one’s rational best to do what is objectively right. Second, more concretely, to be moral is to care about people. Now, rationality and objectivity are impartial; they do not favor one person over another. Hence to be moral is to care about people equally or impartially, so far as one can, which means trying to benefit people as much as one can. So consequentialism is correct.

One worry about these arguments is that if it happens that the most efficient way for you to help people is to send as much money as possible to help desperately poor people you do not know, then your following consequentialism may involve thinking of the people you know mainly as potential sources of money. And if someone thinks of the people she knows that way, it seems a stretch to call her a “loving” or even a “caring” person.

3. Arguments Against Consequentialism

We turn now to some of the most popular reasons to think consequentialism is false and some possible replies to these attacks

a. Partiality

It is in the spirit of consequentialism to look at goodness ultimately from an impartial, impersonal point of view. For example, a Consequentialist who thinks the kind of consequence that matters is happiness is unlikely to think that one person’s happiness is more important than another’s (so long as the amounts of happiness in question are the same). Hence consequentialism tends to hold that in deciding what to do, you ought to give just as much weight to the needs of total strangers as to the needs of your friends, your family, and even yourself. And since your dollar can usually do more good for desperate refugees than for yourself or your friends, consequentialism seems to hold that you ought to spend most of your dollars on strangers. But when you are deciding whom to spend your money on, common sense seems to hold that you are normally morally permitted to favor yourself over strangers and often morally required to favor your children over strangers. Hence consequentialism conflicts with common sense.

One reply to this objection is that since you know better how to help yourself and those near to you, you will get better results if you focus on them rather than people strange to you or out of view. Further, it is more natural for you to want to help those closer to you, so if you start projects to help your own rather than strangers, you are more likely to follow through and less likely to burn out or lose track of your purpose. Hence the consequences will probably be better. Further, those near to you are counting on your help, so that if you stop helping them their plans will be disrupted, while strangers will not be hurt in that way if you do not spend money on them. Further, your ability to think well and act effectively depends in many ways on your having strong relationships with a few people near to you, so that your spending a bit of time or money on these people not only gives them directly a bit of help or happiness, it also indirectly supports all your other projects now and in the future. For all these reasons it would seem that even a consequentialism that impartially counts each person’s happiness or well-being as being of equal value would advise each of us to be somewhat partial to herself and those near to her, because in that way she can produce the best impartial results. And perhaps that is why common sense favors some partiality. See Singer (1972); Jackson (1991); Kidder (2003).

A different kind of reply to the objection is to adjust consequentialism itself so that it is no longer impartial. Here are two simple examples of such theories:

Egoistic Consequentialism: Of all the things a person might do at any given moment, the morally right action is the one that has the best consequences for that person.

Friendly Consequentialism: Of all the things a person might do at any given moment, the morally right action is the one that has the best consequences for that person and her friends.

Theories like these that count the same kinds of consequence differently for each person acting, are sometimes called “agent-relative” forms of consequentialism, though one might wonder whether they are in the spirit of consequentialism at all. See Sen (1982), Nagel (1986), Scheffler (1994), Bennett (1989), Scheffler (1989), Brink (1986), and Skorupski (1995).

b. Equality

For consequentialism, the simplest way to conceive of the goodness of consequences is in terms of how much they contain of something that is considered good, such as happiness or personal well-being, regardless of who gets it. What matters is the total amount, not who gets what. Such a conception is egalitarian in the sense that it counts every bit of your happiness as being just as important as the same sized bits of my happiness. But one could object that in another sense, such a conception is not egalitarian because it does not care whether happiness is distributed equally or unequally among people. If the greatest total can be created only by exploiting the miserable to make the happy even happier, then such consequentialism would seem to say that you should do it. But common sense may rebel against that idea as being unfair or unjust. Hence consequentialism is wrong. See Le Guin (1973); Rawls (1999); Harsanyi (1977).

One reply to this objection is that our intuitive sense of fairness is not mainly concerned with distributions of ultimate goods like happiness or well-being. Rather, fairness is traditionally concerned with distributions of what we might call “external goods” – goods such as money, status, power, and political rights. These are good because of the further goods that they tend to produce. Now, serious inequality in external goods tends to reduce the total happiness. One reason is that, in general, external goods tend to produce more happiness or well-being when they go to people who have less of these goods than when they go to people who have more. For example, an extra dollar does more good for a poor person than for a rich person. That is a reason to think that promoting equality in external goods will tend to do more total good than promoting inequality. Another reason is that when there is more equality in the main external goods, the basic conditions of people’s lives will be more similar and people will find it easier to understand and sympathize with each other. Hence actions and policies that promote equality in external goods will cause more happiness by promoting a sense of community. Further, institutions that secure basic external equalities, or that aim to protect whoever is poorest and weakest, tend to give everyone more security. This makes life nicer and helps people be concerned for each other rather than fearful of each other, and they will therefore do more good for each other. Actions that promote egalitarian institutions, then, would tend to do the most good overall. Perhaps these points are the basis of our sense of the importance of equality.

A different kind of reply to the objection is to propose that one of the ultimate standards for goodness of consequences should be equality. One might propose, for example, that the consequences of an action are good insofar as they promote the total happiness and promote equality of happiness or of other goods. See Sidgwick (1907). However, once one introduces such a complex standard of goodness for consequences, questions arise as to how to rate the relative importance of the parts of the standard and about how such a view can be given theoretical elegance.

c. Personal Rights

Consequentialism may ask us to meddle too much into other people’s business. For example, perhaps we can do the most good overall if we forcibly stop people from wasting their time and energy on pointless or harmful things like driving SUVs, watching television, eating meat, following sports, and so on. See Frey (1984).

For a more extreme example of meddling, suppose that by using your grandmother’s pension to contribute to efficient and thoughtful charities you can develop permanent clean water supplies for many distant villages, thus saving hundreds of people from painful early deaths and permitting economic development to begin. You need only keep her bound and gagged in the cellar and force her to sign the checks. Consequentialism would seem to say that you should do this, but moral common sense says that you should not. Hence consequentialism is opposed to common sense and is probably wrong.

For another example, suppose you are a surgeon with five patients, each about to die for lack of a certain medicine that you can obtain (in sufficient quantity) only by killing and grinding up a sixth patient. Should you do it? Consequentialism says you should do this; but moral common sense says that you should not. Hence consequentialism is opposed to common sense and so is probably wrong. Foot (1967).

Now, one reply to the extreme examples is that such opportunities are extremely unusual. (At least that is true of the surgery example.) Moral common sense is shaped by and for the demands of ordinary moral life and so common sense may not be very reliable in odd cases. Hence the fact that consequentialism disagrees with common sense about odd cases is no disproof of consequentialism.

Another reply to the extreme examples is to point out that although they rely on secrecy, they overlook secrecy’s consequential drawbacks. To keep a big secret, you must actively mislead and deceive people and keep them at a distance. Continued deception about a serious matter is difficult, so at the outset you must take into account the chance that you will fail or give up. See Jackson (1991). Continued difficult deception uses up mental resources. Hence if you have such a secret, your further projects will be more poorly chosen, designed, and carried out. Also, if you have important secrets, you may find it hard to have ordinary trust for others; you may become somewhat paranoid and ineffective. Further, if you have a big secret that would repel nice honest people, any nice honest person who learns your secret will not want to be your friend. Anyone who does not know your secret will not really know you and hence cannot be your real friend. But we need nice honest friends if we are to be effective doers of good in the long run. We need them for practical help, for mental health, and to help us see ourselves clearly. We need to see ourselves clearly in order to do good effectively in the long run. Now, if you are the sort of person who actually would send money to save distant strangers, anything that cripples your efforts will hurt many people. Hence the reasonable expectation is that embezzling your grandmother’s checks would have terrible consequences. And if you are a skilled surgeon, anything that hampers your operations will hurt people. Hence the reasonable expectation is that harvesting the healthy patient would have bad consequences. A similar argument might be made regarding almost any scheme that would horrify nice honest people.

A more general reply to the claim that consequentialism advises us to meddle in other people’s business is that even where secrecy would not be involved, there are Consequentialist reasons for you to avoid direct meddling with others’ private spheres and personal affairs. For one thing, each of us is in a better position to understand her own affairs than you are and more naturally and reliably concerned than you are to make sure that her own affairs are carried out well. If you get involved in meddling, can you trust yourself to meddle in the right direction and with adequate care? If you want to do good for me, doing the sorts of things that are normally thought of as violating my personal rights is probably a bad bet. That does not mean consequentialism tells you to leave me entirely alone. Consequentialism can still tell you to give me resources or opportunities, or to help me with my projects, or to help improve the laws of our community.

Further, it is important that people be free to make decisions for themselves, even poor decisions, because that is the only way that people develop strength of character and because constant experimentation is the only way humanity learns about the various possibilities of life. Hence consequentialism would seem to ask us to support laws that protect personal freedom against excessive interference by our neighbors or our government. See Mill (1859).

A different kind of reply to the objection is to propose a new standard for the goodness of consequences. One might propose, for example, that an action is good insofar as it decreases the amount of meddling in the world. Or one might propose instead that an action is good insofar as it causes less meddling and more total happiness. Of course, once one introduces such a complex standard of goodness for consequences, questions arise about how to rate the relative importance of the parts of the standard and about how such a view can be given theoretical elegance. A further worry about this new proposal is that it still does not directly tell us not to meddle. For if we can minimize the total amount of meddling in the long run by meddling today (perhaps by spying on terrorism suspects or by privately bombing the citizens of aggressive countries), this new theory tells us to do so. See Sen (1982).

d. Human Thinking

Consequentialism seems to tell us to make all our decisions by thinking about overall consequences. But that way of thinking about life is, one might think, inhuman and immoral. When someone asks you a question, you should not stop to calculate the consequences before deciding whether to answer truthfully. If you decide by looking to the consequences, you are not really an honest person. Also, when you are about to follow through on a project you have started, you should not stop to calculate the overall consequences anew before you proceed. A sane person will decide on a project and then simply follow through, unless some new situation arises. Anyone who stops to calculate consequences before taking any step to fulfill a commitment is not a person of integrity. And what moves you to spend an hour with your friend or spouse or child should not be impartial calculations about the overall impact on the world at large. If you decide by looking to the overall consequences, you do not really love that person. Therefore consequentialism is an inhuman and immoral theory and must be wrong. See Williams (1973); Williams (1981); Stocker (1976).

Now, this objection does not directly apply to Plain Consequentialism or Plain Scalar Consequentialism, for these theories do not say that we should think about consequences. On the contrary, if you think in the inhuman way described in the objection, your plans and your relationships are unlikely to go well, so Plain versions of consequentialism tend to oppose that way of thinking. Such thinking would be action that has bad consequences. See Bales (1971), Railton (1994).

Nor does the objection apply to Rule Consequentialism. Rule Consequentialism suggests that we should evaluate rules of behavior by asking what the consequences would be if everyone accepted this or that rule, but does not say that the rightness of actions has anything to do with the consequences of those actions themselves. See Rawls (1955).

The objection does, however, directly attack Reasonable Consequentialism and Dual Consequentialism, because these theories say that an action is morally wrong unless we have a reasonable estimate of its consequences.

The defender of Reasonable or Dual Consequentialism might argue that the objection has misunderstood what it is to have a reasonable estimate of an action’s consequences. Perhaps it does not involve explicitly thinking about the consequences at all. As I proceed to feed my cat, I almost never think about the consequences of doing so versus not doing so, but surely it would be wrong to say that I have no view or that my view is not reasonable.

Another way of replying to the objection is to propose yet another version of consequentialism.

Double Consequentialism: The word “right” is ambiguous. It has a moral sense and an objective sense. (i) The objectively right action is the action with the best consequences, and (ii) the morally right action is any action one reasonably estimates to be objectively right.

This Double Consequentialism differs from the Dual Consequentialism of 1.e above only in point (ii), on the morally right action. Where Dual Consequentialism had said that the morally right action is “any action with the best reasonably expected consequences,” Double Consequentialism says the morally right action is the action one reasonably estimates to be objectively right. To see the difference in principle between these theories, suppose there is a somewhat reliable authority on what specific kinds of actions are objectively right. For example, suppose God, who knows all the consequences, has announced that certain kinds of things are right. Or suppose a society’s conventional views about what is right and wrong reflect centuries of experience about what tends to cause trouble. Or suppose the recommendation that comes from you friend, your mother, your heart, or your prior resolution, reflects insight into the implications of your action that would not be reflected in the conscious estimates of consequences you might be able to work up on the spur of the moment. Further, suppose that God, society, your friend or your heart has sufficient authority on the points it addresses that the most reasonable way for you to estimate which of your own options are objectively right is to trust that authority. If there is such an authority, then actions one chooses by deferring to the authority may be morally right according to Double Consequentialism even if they are morally wrong according to Dual Consequentialism.

For example, suppose Paul is considering stealing money from his grandmother to help the poor. So far as he can reasonably guess, that scheme would have the best overall consequences. But he remembers that stealing is generally regarded as wrong. He may or may not find consequentialism plausible, but in any case he knows he does not have a solid theoretical understanding of rightness; so he reasonably decides to trust his community’s confident view and does not pursue the scheme. Double Consequentialism says his choice is morally right, even though his decision was not based on estimates of consequences and went against his estimates.

One might object that if the objectively right action is the one whose consequences are best, then general social opinion cannot be an authority on objective rightness, even on those issues where the general opinion is clear. For general social opinion does not agree that the objectively right action is the one whose consequences are best.

But this objection assumes that an authority on the question whether an action is objectively right would have to know exactly what objective rightness is. That assumption may be mistaken, because it is not true that an authority on whether something has a certain feature has to know exactly what that feature is. For example, suppose that many years ago, before anyone knew that gold is made of atoms or that it is the element with atomic number 79, Jack and Jill were hiking in unclaimed land and came upon some heavy shiny lumps. Jack had no idea how to identify gold. But Jill had handled gold a few times before and could make a good guess about whether the lumps were really gold. For the moment, Jill was an authority for Jack on whether these lumps were gold. It was reasonable for him to rely on her imperfect judgment, even though neither of them knew quite what gold is.

Since Double Consequentialism does not imply that you should estimate the consequences of your everyday actions, it seems to escape the objection that consequentialism requires inhuman and immoral thinking.

4. Further Arguments for Consequentialism

a. Reasons for Action

One argument for consequentialism begins from the premise that whatever a person does, she does in order to produce some sort of good result. It may be a benefit to herself or to someone else. It may be a short-run benefit or a long-run benefit. It may be a benefit of a particular kind: a financial benefit, a heath benefit, entertainment or knowledge. It may be the prevention of some harm. But whatever a person does, she does in order to produce some sort of benefit. Her expectation that it will produce or promote that good outcome is her reason for performing the action. Now, different kinds of benefits yield different kinds of reasons. For example, if a certain action would be good for the bank account but bad for the health, there is a financial reason for it and a health reason against it. Similarly, if a certain action would be good for me but bad for you, there is a reason for it and a reason against it. To find out whether the action is rationally justifiable overall, one must look beyond these specific kinds of reason to find what overall reason there is. That is, one must look to see whether financial benefit outweighs the health drawback, and whether the benefit to me outweighs the harm to you. In other words, one must ask whether the action promotes benefit overall. Therefore, an action is rationally justifiable insofar as it does good overall. And since we ought to do what is rationally justifiable, we ought to do whatever does the most good overall. Hence Consequentialism is true.

One worry about the above argument is that its initial premise may be false. We may sometimes act not to produce a benefit, but in order to obey a principle we accept. For example, you may do something simply because you have promised or because it is required by law, without looking to the consequences. Even if every action does aim at some benefit, this does not show that the benefit is the whole reason for each action. Perhaps our reason for each action is a combination of two things: the idea that the action will produce benefits and the idea that the action is morally permissible—that it would not violate any principles of morality. If every action is taken to produce some benefit, that shows only that the benefit is part of the reason for every action, not that the benefit is the whole reason.

Another worry about the above argument is that it presupposes that the notion of overall benefit makes sense. To see how someone might question that, think about skills and skill. Many of our actions are aimed at developing skill. But skill is not one thing. Many of our actions are aimed at developing a skil. To practice one skill, one must neglect or even undermine another skill. (Boxing makes me worse at the piano.) But that does not imply that there is a kind of skill that is neither boxing nor piano but simply “overall skill,” nor does it imply that my training actions are irrational unless I think they will promote overall skill. See Foot (1985); Scanlon (1998).

b. It Is Wrong to Choose the Worse Over the Better

Consider the following argument for consequentialism adapted from Foot (1985).

The whole of an action’s consequences has no further consequences. (Premise)
When we are choosing among such wholes, nothing else is at stake. (From 1)
It can never be right to choose something worse over something better, when nothing else is at stake. (Premise)
It can never be right to choose a worse whole set of consequences over a better. (From 2 and 3)
In choosing an action, one is choosing its whole set of consequences. (Premise)
One ought always to choose an action whose overall consequences are at least as good as the overall consequences of any of the alternative actions; in other words, consequentialism is true. (From 4 and 5)

A worry about the argument is that premise (5) may not be true. In choosing an action, one is normally not choosing its whole set of consequences, because one cannot know what most of the consequences are. One is normally not even choosing the reasonably expectable consequences, because one has not formed any expectation about the action’s likely overall consequences.

A second worry is that premise (1) may not support statement (2). Even though a whole set of consequences has no further consequences, it might have further implications. For not all implications are consequences. For example, one important implication of the fact that my speedometer’s hand is below the ‘55’ is that I am going slower than 55. That is why the position of the hand matters to me. But of course I know that the position of the hand has no effect on my speed. For another example, one important implication of an action I take may be that I (already) am a certain kind of person. An action can show what kind of person I am even if it does not make me be that kind of person. See Campbell and Sowden (1985).

A third worry about the above argument begins from a view about the adjective ‘good’. What we are saying about a knife when we say that it is a “good” one is very different from what we are saying about a painting when we say that it is a “good” one; and similarly the import of ‘good’ seems to differ in the phrases ‘good mathematician’, ‘good liar’, ‘good father’, and ‘good batch of crack’. Thus it would seem that the standards of goodness vary with the kind of thing we are talking about. Now, some kinds of thing do not suggest any standards of goodness: consider ‘good pebble’. If I point to a pebble and say that it is a “good pebble,” you will not know what I mean. Hence ‘good’ seems not to have a meaning in that context. To say that a certain pebble is good is meaningless. Similarly, there are no general standards of goodness for whole sets of consequences in genera. The phrase ‘good whole set of consequences’ is no more communicative or meaningful than the phrase ‘good pebble’. If that is right, then consequentialism itself must be wrong because consequentialism is at root the idea that we ought to bring about good consequences. See Geach (1956); Foot (1985); Thomson (1993).

This controversial line of thought is not only an objection to the above argument for consequentialism, it is also an argument against consequentialism. For if ‘good consequences’ is meaningless, then it cannot be correct to define right action in terms of good consequences, as consequentialism normally does.

One possible reply to this argument against consequentialism is that even if ‘good overall consequences’ turns out to be meaningless, one might still think, for example, that the right action is the one that causes the most happiness. One could phrase consequentialism in general terms as, for example, the theory that “there is some feature of consequences of actions such that the right action is the one whose consequences have that feature to the greatest degree.”

The remaining arguments for consequentialism given here, like the argument from love, do not speak merely of “good consequences overall.” Rather they defend consequentialism by defending the importance of some particular kind of consequence, such as happiness, the satisfaction of desire, or the well-being of people.

c. The Ideal Spectator

Consider the following argument for consequentialism.

What objectively ought to happen, what is objectively desirable, is whatever would be wished for by a spectator with full knowledge and no bias; that is, someone who knows everything and is equally sympathetic with everyone. (Premise)
An impartially sympathetic being who knows everyone’s desires would share everyone’s desires in proportion to their strength. (Premise)
An all-knowing impartial being would, overall, wish for the greatest possible balance of satisfaction of the desires of all people. (From 2)
What objectively ought to happen is whatever would promote the greatest possible balance of satisfaction of the desires of all people. (From 1 and 3)
The right action is the one that objectively ought to happen. (Premise)
The right action is whatever would promote the greatest possible balance of satisfaction of the desires of all people. (From 4 and 5)
Consequentialism is true. (From 6)

One worry about the above argument is that it is not clear why we should think Premise 1 is true. Why would the absence of bias mean being equally sympathetic with everyone? Perhaps an easier way to be free of bias is to have no sympathy for anyone.

Another worry is that 1 and 2 do not imply 3. For one thing, 1 and 2 do not tell us that the ideal spectator would have no concerns other than those she derives from sympathy, but 3 does make that assumption. For another thing, suppose this amazing being does lack all other concerns. Now, 2 tells us that she is full of desires that conflict with each other. 3 says that she has another desire—the desire that all her other desires be fulfilled as much as possible. Why would she have that additional desire? One might suppose that if a person has two conflicting desires, it is rational for her to replace them with a single compromise desire. But if the spectator replaces her conflicting desires, then according to 2 she no longer has the sympathy that makes her a reliable judge. See Firth (1952); Hare (1981), Seanor and Fotion (1988).

d. What is Desirable

Consider this argument for Plain Scalar Consequentialism, which is based on one proposed in Mill (1861):

Desiring something is the same thing as thinking that it will increase one’s happiness or decrease one’s unhappiness. (Premise)
What each person ultimately desires is only her own happiness. (From 1)
What will satisfy each person’s desire is her own happiness—and whatever promotes that. (From 2)
“X is desirable” means “If X occurs, X will help satisfy desire.” (Premise)
What is ultimately desirable for each person is her own happiness—and whatever promotes that. (From 3 and 4)
“Good” and “desirable” are synonyms. (Premise)
What is good for you is happiness for you —and whatever promotes that. (From 5 and 6)
8. What is good is happiness—and whatever promotes that. (From 7, crossing ‘for you’ out of both sides of the equation)
An action is good insofar as its overall consequences contain happiness. (From 8)
Plain Scalar Consequentialism is true. (From 9)

One worry about this argument is that 1 seems false. For example, people often procrastinate from laziness or fear, knowing that they are hurting themselves in the long run. And even people who do not believe in a life after death often give their lives for larger causes.

Another worry is that it is unclear exactly how 7 is supposed to imply 8. Even in mathematics, crossing the same thing out of both sides of a true equation does not always yield a new true equation. If you cross out “+2” from both sides of “10+2 = 3(2+2),” you change a truth to a falsehood.

A shorter cousin of the above argument, focusing on the fulfillment of desire rather than on happiness, avoids those worries.

“X is desirable” means “X will help satisfy desire if, X occurs.” (Premise)
The words “good” and “desirable” are synonyms. (Premise)
An action is good insofar as it helps to satisfy desire. (From 1 and 2)
An action is good insofar as its consequences include the satisfaction of desire. (From 3)
Consequentialism is true. (From 4)

One worry about this shorter argument is that Premise 2 may be false. For example, it sounds a bit odd to say that when you call someone a good person, you are calling her a desirable person.

Another worry is that it is obscure whether there is anything sensible that might be meant by a greater or lesser amount of “satisfaction of desire.” Are all desires to count or only those that exist at the time of the action or the decision (even if they disappear before most of the consequences arrive)? Presumably the stronger desires are to count for more. But if I desire something slightly and then intensely, which counts? Should a desire count for more if it is held for a longer time? Should it count if it is based on a factual mistake or if it is malicious? See Griffin (1986); Scanlon (1993).

e. Common Sense

There are many moral questions on which common sense is divided or simply stumped. People disagree with each other about the morality of using human embryos for stem cell research, downloading copyrighted music, giving little to the poor, eating animals, having certain kinds of sex, and many other things. One of the main reasons to investigate moral theory is to learn how to approach these questions reasonably.

But on many issues there is a broad range of solid agreement about what is morally obvious, at least in societies that have long permitted open discussion by all. We firmly agree, for example, that equality and rights are very important, that it is not wrong to favor our family and friends over strangers, that it is wrong to torture children, and so on. When we are thinking about morality, that is usually because we are puzzled about some hard question. At such times we might overlook the fact that the aspects of morality that we agree on as obvious cover so much territory that they sketch the basic shape of civilized life.

Yet there is not broad agreement on the abstract question, “What is morality all about? What is morality?” Consequentialism is, as we have seen, one of many different proposed answers to that question. The true answer would presumably have some sort of simplicity and would presumably support most of the concrete moral views that seem most obvious to our common sense. So if consequentialism agrees with common sense, that agreement is some reason to think that consequentialism is true.

Section 3 above presented several objections to consequentialism, arguing that consequentialism conflicts with one or another basic piece of common sense about morality. But in reply to most of these objections, Section 3 presented arguments to show that consequentialism supports those bits of common sense after all.

A worry about this line of thought is that if there were some simple theory like consequentialism that captured what morality is about, one might think that we would have recognized it long ago. But consequentialism is still controversial.

(For more discussion of consequentialism, see the consequentialism section of the article Ethics.)

5. References and Further Reading

a. Classic Works

Bentham, Jeremy (J. H. Burns and H. L. A. Hart, eds.). An Introduction to the Principles of Morals and Legislation [1789]. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1996.
Mill, John Stuart (Roger Crisp, ed.), Utilitarianism [1861]. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1998.
Sidgwick, Henry. 1907. The Methods of Ethics, Seventh Edition [1907]. Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing Company, 1981.
Moore, G. E. (Thomas Baldwin, ed.) Principia Ethica [1903]. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1993.

b. Recommended Collections

Most of the best recent work on consequentialism is collected in the following anthologies. Any one of these collections provides an excellent introduction to consequentialism. In addition, the fine journal Utilitas is entirely devoted to the topic.

Darwall, Stephen. Consequentialism. Oxford: Blackwell Publishing, 2003.
Gorovitz, Samuel, ed. John Stuart Mill: Utilitarianism, With Critical Essays. Indianapolis: The Bobbs-Merrill Company, 1971.
Pettit, Philip, ed. Consequentialism (International Research Library of Philosophy, Vol. 6). Aldershot: Dartmouth Publishing Group, 1993.
Scheffler, Samuel, ed. Consequentialism and Its Critics. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1988.

c. Other Recommended Works

Adams, Robert M. “Motive Utilitarianism.” Journal of Philosophy 73 (1976): 467-481.
Bales, R. Eugene. “Act-Utilitarianism: Account of Right-Making Characteristics or Decision-Making Procedures?” American Philosophical Quarterly 8 (1971): 257-65.
Bayles, Michael D., ed. Contemporary Utilitarianism.. Garden City: Doubleday, 1968.
Bennett, Jonathan. “Two Departures from Consequentialism.” Ethics 100.1 (1989): 54-66.
Brandt, Richard. B. A Theory of the Good and the Right. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1979.
Brandt, Richard B. Morality, Utilitarianism, and Rights. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1992.
Brink, David. “Utilitarian Morality and the Personal Point of View.” Journal of Philosophy 83.8 (1986): 417-38.
Brink, David. Moral Realism and the Foundations of Ethics. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1989
Campbell, Richmond, and Sowden, Lanning, eds. Paradoxes of Rationality and Cooperation. Vancouver: University of British Columbia Press, 1985.
Den Uyl, Douglas, & Machan, Tibor R. “Recent Work on the Concept of Happiness.” American Philosophical Quarterly 20.2 (1983): 115-134
Driver, Julia, ed. Character and Consequentialism. Special Issue of Utilitas, 13.2 (2001).
Feldman, Fred. Utilitarianism, Hedonism, and Desert. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1997.
Firth, Roderick. “Ethical Absolutism and the Ideal Observer.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 12 (1952): 317-345.
Foot, Philippa. “The Problem of Abortion and the Doctrine of Double Effect.” Oxford Review 5 (1967): 28-41.
Foot, Philippa. “Utilitarianism and the Virtues.” Mind 94 (1985): 196-209.
Frey, Raymond. G. Utility and Rights. Oxford: Basil Blackwell, 1984.
Geach, Peter. “Good and Evil.” Analysis 17 (1956): 33-42.
Goodin, Robert E. Utilitarianism as a Public Philosophy. New York: Cambridge University Press, 1995.
Griffin, James. Well-Being. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1986.
Hare, Richard M. Moral Thinking. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1981.
Harsanyi, John. C. “Morality and the Theory of Rational Behavior.” Social Research 44.4 (1977): 623-656.
Hart, H. L. A. “Natural Rights: Bentham and John Stuart Mill.” In Essays on Bentham: Studies in Jurisprudence and Political Theory, by H. L. A. Hart. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1982.
Hooker, Brad, ed. Rationality, Rationality, Rules, and Utility: New Essays on the Moral Philosophy of Richard Brandt. Boulder: Westview Press, 1993.
Hooker, Brad. “Rule Consequentialism.” Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
Hooker, Brad; Mason, Elinor; and Miller, Dale E. Morality, Rules, and Consequences. Edinburgh: Edinburgh University Press, 2000.
Jackson, Frank. “Decision-Theoretic Consequentialism and the Nearest and Dearest Objection.” Ethics 101 (1991): 461-82.
Jackson, Frank, and Pargetter, Robert. “Oughts, Options, and Actualism.” Philosophical Review 95 (1986): 233-255.
Kagan, Shelly. The Limits of Morality. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1989.
Kagan, Shelly. Normative Ethics. Boulder: Westview, 1998.
Kidder, Tracy. Mountains Beyond Mountains. New York: Random House, 2003.
Le Guin, Ursula K. The Ones Who Walk Away From Omelas [1973]. Mankato, MN: Creative Education, 1992.
Lyons, David. Forms and Limits of Utilitarianism. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1965.
Mill, John Stuart. On Liberty [1859] in John Gray and G. W. Smith, eds., J. S. Mill’s On Liberty in Focus. London: Routledge, 1991.
Mulgan, Tim, “Two Conceptions of Benevolence.” Philosophy and Public Affairs 26.1 (1997):62-79.
Mulgan, Tim. The Demands of Consequentialism. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 2001.
Murphy, Liam B. “A Relatively Plausible Principle of Beneficence: Reply to Mulgan.” Philosophy and Public Affairs 26.1 (1997):80-86.
Nagel, Thomas. The View From Nowhere. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1986.
Norcross, Alastair. “Good and Bad Actions.” Philosophical Review 106.1(1997): 1-34.
Nozick, Robert. Anarchy, State, and Utopia. New York: Basic Books, 1974.
Parfit, Derek. Reasons and Persons. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1984.
Pettit, Philip. “The Consequentialist Perspective.” In Three Methods of Ethics, by Marcia Baron, Philip Pettit, and Michael Slote. Oxford: Blackwell Publishing, 1997.
Railton, Peter. “How Thinking about Character and Utilitarianism Might Lead to Rethinking the Character of Utilitarianism.” Midwest Studies in Philosophy, 13 (1988): 398-416.
Railton, Peter. “Alienation, Consequentialism, and the Demands of Morality,” Philosophy and Public Affairs, 13.2 (1994): 134-71.
Rawls, John. “Two Concepts of Rules” Philosophical Review 64 (1955): 3-32.
Rawls, John. A Theory of Justice, Revised Edition. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1999. Scanlon, Thomas M. “Value, Desire, and Quality of Life.” In Martha Nussbaum and Amartya Sen, eds., The Quality of Life. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1993.
Scanlon, Thomas M. What We Owe to Each Other. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1998.
Scarre, Geoffrey. Utilitarianism. London: Routledge, 1996.
Scheffler, Samuel. “Deontology and the Agent: A Reply to Bennett” Ethics 100.1 (1989): 67-76.
Scheffler, Samuel. The Rejection of Consequentialism, Revised Edition. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1994.
Seanor, Douglas, & Fotion, N. Hare and Critics. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1988.
Sen, Amartya. “Rights and Agency.” Philosophy and Public Affairs 11.1 (1982): 3-39.
Sen, Amartya, and Williams, Bernard, eds. Utilitarianism and Beyond. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1982.
Shaw, William. H. Contemporary Ethics: Taking Account of Utilitarianism. Malden: Blackwell Publishing, 1999.
Singer, Marcus G. “Actual Consequence Utilitarianism.” Mind 86 (1977): 67-77.
Singer, Peter. “Famine, Affluence, and Morality.” Philosophy and Public Affairs 1 (1972): 229-243.
Singer, Peter. Practical Ethics, Second Edition. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1993.
Sinnott-Armstrong, Walter. “Consequentialism.” In The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
Skorupski, John. “Agent-Neutrality, Consequentialism, Utilitarianism: A Terminological Note.” Utilitas 7 (1995): 49-54.
Slote, Michael. “Object Utilitarianism,” Pacific Philosophical Quarterly 66 (1985): 111-124.
Slote, Michael. Common-Sense Morality and Consequentialism. London: Routledge and Kegan Paul, 1985.
Slote, Michael. Beyond Optimizing. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1989.
Smart, J. J. C., “Free Will, Praise, and Blame,” Mind 70.279 (1961): 291-306.
Smart, J. J. C. “An Outline of a System of Utilitarian Ethics.” In Utilitarianism: For and Against, by J. J. C. Smart and Bernard Williams. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1973.
Sprigge, T. L. S. The Rational Foundations of Ethics. London: Routledge & Kegan Paul, 1988.
Stocker, Michael. “The Schizophrenia of Modern Ethical Theories.” Journal of Philosophy 73 (1976): 453-466.
Sumner, L. W. Welfare, Happiness, and Ethics. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1996.
Tännsjö, Torbjörn. Hedonistic Utilitarianism. Edinburgh: Edinburgh University Press, 1998.
Taurek, John. “Should the Numbers Count?” Philosophy & Public Affairs 6 (1977): 293-316.
Thomson, Judith Jarvis. “Goodness and Utilitarianism.” Proceedings and Addresses of the American Philosophical Association 67.2 (October 1993): 145-159.
Williams, Bernard. “A Critique of Utilitarianism,” in Utilitarianism: For and Against, by J.J.C. Smart and Bernard Williams. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1973.
Williams, Bernard. “Persons, Character, and Morality,” in Bernard Williams, Moral Luck. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1981.

Author Information

William Haines
Email: hainesw@hkucc.hku.hk
The University of Hong Kong
China

Alfred North Whitehead (1861—1947)

Table of Contents

1. Biography

2. Thought and Writings

a. Major Thematic Structures

b. The Early Mathematical Works

c. Writings on Education

d. The Philosophy of Nature

e. The Metaphysical Works

3. Influence and Legacy

4. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

b. Secondary Sources

Author Information

God and Time

Table of Contents

1. God’s Relation to Time — Preliminaries

a. What it Means to be Temporal: A First Pass

b. What it Means to be Timeless: A First Pass

c. Some In-between Views

2. Methodology

3. Divine Timelessness

a. Stump and Kretzmann: Timelessness as Duration

b. Leftow: Timelessness as Quasi-Temporal Eternity

c. Rogers: Timelessness with No Duration

4. Arguments for Divine Timelessness

a. God’s Knowledge of the Future

b. The Fullness of God’s Being

c. God and the Creation of the Universe

5. Divine Temporality

6. Arguments for Temporality

a. Divine Action in the World

b. Divine Knowledge of the Present

7. Some In-between Views

a. Padgett and DeWeese: God as Relatively Timeless

b. Craig: God as Timeless without Creation and Temporal with Creation

8. Conclusion

9. References and Further Reading

Author Information

Environmental Ethics

Table of Contents

1. Extending Moral Standing

a. Human Beings

b. Animals

c. Individual Living Organisms

d. Holistic Entities

2. Radical Ecology

a. Deep Ecology

b. Social Ecology

c. Ecofeminism

3. The Future of Environmental Ethics

4. References and Further Reading

Author Information

Process Philosophy

Table of Contents

1. What Counts as Process Philosophy

a. The Perennial Process Tradition

b. The Whitehead-Hartshorne Tradition

2. Assumptions and Method

a. In Pursuit of a Holistic Worldview

b. Neo-Classical Realism

c. Speculative Metaphysics

3. Basic Metaphysics

a. Creativity as Ultimate

b. Events, not Substances

c. Internal and External Relations

d. Rejection of Nominalism

4. The Human Person

a. Panexperientialism with Organizational Duality

b. Perception and Prehension

5. God and the World

a. Dipolar Panentheism

b. Freedom and the Problem of Evil

6. Non-theistic Variations

7. Process Philosophy as Constructive Postmodernism

8. Conclusion

9. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

b. Secondary Sources

Author Information

Model-Theoretic Conceptions of
Logical Consequence