A Priori and A Posteriori

The terms “a priori” and “a posteriori” are used primarily to denote the foundations upon which a proposition is known. A given proposition is knowable a priori if it can be known independent of any experience other than the experience of learning the language in which the proposition is expressed, whereas a proposition that is knowable a posteriori is known on the basis of experience. For example, the proposition that all bachelors are unmarried is a priori, and the proposition that it is raining outside now is a posteriori.

The distinction between the two terms is epistemological and immediately relates to the justification for why a given item of knowledge is held. For instance, a person who knows (a priori) that “All bachelors are unmarried” need not have experienced the unmarried status of all—or indeed any—bachelors to justify this proposition. By contrast, if I know that “It is raining outside,” knowledge of this proposition must be justified by appealing to someone’s experience of the weather.

The a priori /a posteriori distinction, as is shown below, should not be confused with the similar dichotomy of the necessary and the contingent or the dichotomy of the analytic and the synthetic. Nonetheless, the a priori /a posteriori distinction is itself not without controversy. The major sticking-points historically have been how to define the concept of the “experience” on which the distinction is grounded, and whether or in what sense knowledge can indeed exist independently of all experience. The latter issue raises important questions regarding the positive, that is, actual, basis of a priori knowledge — questions which a wide range of philosophers have attempted to answer. Kant, for instance, advocated a “transcendental” form of justification involving “rational insight” that is connected to, but does not immediately arise from, empirical experience.

This article provides an initial characterization of the terms “a priori” and “a posteriori,” before illuminating the differences between the distinction and those with which it has commonly been confused. It will then review the main controversies that surround the topic and explore opposing accounts of a positive basis of a priori knowledge that seek to avoid an account exclusively reliant on pure thought for justification.

Table of Contents

1. An Initial Characterization
2. The Analytic/Synthetic Distinction
3. The Necessary/Contingent Distinction
4. The Relevant Sense of “Experience”
5. The Relevant Sense of “Independent”
6. Positive Characterizations of the A Priori
7. References and Further Reading

1. An Initial Characterization

“A priori” and “a posteriori” refer primarily to how, or on what basis, a proposition might be known. In general terms, a proposition is knowable a priori if it is knowable independently of experience, while a proposition knowable a posteriori is knowable on the basis of experience. The distinction between a priori and a posteriori knowledge thus broadly corresponds to the distinction between empirical and nonempirical knowledge.

The a priori/a posteriori distinction is sometimes applied to things other than ways of knowing, for instance, to propositions and arguments. An a priori proposition is one that is knowable a priori and an a priori argument is one the premises of which are a priori propositions. Correspondingly, an a posteriori proposition is knowable a posteriori, while an a posteriori argument is one the premises of which are a posteriori propositions. (An argument is typically regarded as a posteriori if it is comprised of a combination of a priori and a posteriori premises.) The a priori/a posteriori distinction has also been applied to concepts. An a priori concept is one that can be acquired independently of experience, which may – but need not – involve its being innate, while the acquisition of an a posteriori concept requires experience.

The component of knowledge to which the a priori/a posteriori distinction is immediately relevant is that of justification or warrant. (These terms are used synonymously here and refer to the main component of knowledge beyond that of true belief.) To say that a person knows a given proposition a priori is to say that her justification for believing this proposition is independent of experience. According to the traditional view of justification, to be justified in believing something is to have an epistemic reason to support it, a reason for thinking it is true. Thus, to be a priori justified in believing a given proposition is to have a reason for thinking that the proposition is true that does not emerge or derive from experience. By contrast, to be a posteriori justified is to have a reason for thinking that a given proposition is true that does emerge or derive from experience. (See Section 6 below for two accounts of the a priori/a posteriori distinction that do not presuppose this traditional conception of justification.) Examples of a posteriori justification include many ordinary perceptual, memorial, and introspective beliefs, as well as belief in many of the claims of the natural sciences. My belief that it is presently raining, that I administered an exam this morning, that humans tend to dislike pain, that water is H₂O, and that dinosaurs existed, are all examples of a posteriori justification. I have good reasons to support each of these claims and these reasons emerge from my own experience or from that of others. These beliefs stand in contrast with the following: all bachelors are unmarried; cubes have six sides; if today is Tuesday then today is not Thursday; red is a color; seven plus five equals twelve. I have good reasons for thinking each of these claims is true, but the reasons do not appear to derive from experience. Rather, I seem able to see or apprehend the truth of these claims just by reflecting on their content.

The description of a priori justification as justification independent of experience is of course entirely negative, for nothing about the positive or actual basis of such justification is revealed. But the examples of a priori justification noted above do suggest a more positive characterization, namely, that a priori justification emerges from pure thought or reason. Once the meaning of the relevant terms is understood, it is evident on the basis of pure thought that if today is Tuesday then today is not Thursday, or when seven is added to five the resulting sum must be twelve. We can thus refine the characterization of a priori justification as follows: one is a priori justified in believing a given proposition if, on the basis of pure thought or reason, one has a reason to think that the proposition is true.

These initial considerations of the a priori/a posteriori distinction suggest a number of important avenues of investigation. For instance, on what kind of experience does a posteriori justification depend? In what sense is a priori justification independent of this kind of experience? And is a more epistemically illuminating account of the positive character of a priori justification available: one that explains how or in virtue of what pure thought or reason might generate epistemic reasons? But before turning to these issues, the a priori/a posteriori distinction must be differentiated from two related distinctions with which it is sometimes confused: analytic/synthetic; and necessary/contingent.

2. The Analytic/Synthetic Distinction

The analytic/synthetic distinction has been explicated in numerous ways and while some have deemed it fundamentally misguided (e.g., Quine 1961), it is still employed by a number of philosophers today. One standard way of marking the distinction, which has its origin in Kant (1781), turns on the notion of conceptual containment. By this account, a proposition is analytic if the predicate concept of the proposition is contained within the subject concept. The claim that all bachelors are unmarried, for instance, is analytic because the concept of being unmarried is included within the concept of a bachelor. By contrast, in synthetic propositions, the predicate concept “amplifies” or adds to the subject concept. The claim, for example, that the sun is approximately 93 million miles from the earth is synthetic because the concept of being located a certain distance from the earth goes beyond or adds to the concept of the sun itself. A related way of drawing the distinction is to say that a proposition is analytic if its truth depends entirely on the definition of its terms (that is, it is true by definition), while the truth of a synthetic proposition depends not on mere linguistic convention, but on how the world actually is in some respect. The claim that all bachelors are unmarried is true simply by the definition of “bachelor,” while the truth of the claim about the distance between the earth and the sun depends, not merely on the meaning of the term “sun,” but on what this distance actually is.

Some philosophers have equated the analytic with the a priori and the synthetic with the a posteriori. There is, to be sure, a close connection between the concepts. For instance, if the truth of a certain proposition is, say, strictly a matter of the definition of its terms, knowledge of this proposition is unlikely to require experience (rational reflection alone will likely suffice). On the other hand, if the truth of a proposition depends on how the world actually is in some respect, then knowledge of it would seem to require empirical investigation.

Despite this close connection, the two distinctions are not identical. First, the a priori/a posteriori distinction is epistemological: it concerns how, or on what basis, a proposition might be known or justifiably believed. The analytic/synthetic distinction, by contrast, is logical or semantical: it refers to what makes a given proposition true, or to certain intentional relations that obtain between concepts that constitute a proposition.

It is open to question, moreover, whether the a priori even coincides with the analytic or the a posteriori with the synthetic. First, many philosophers have thought that there are (or at least might be) instances of synthetic a priori justification. Consider, for example, the claim that if something is red all over then it is not green all over. Belief in this claim is apparently justifiable independently of experience. Simply by thinking about what it is for something to be red all over, it is immediately clear that a particular object with this quality cannot, at the same time, have the quality of being green all over. But it also seems clear that the proposition in question is not analytic. Being green all over is not part of the definition of being red all over, nor is it included within the concept of being red all over. If examples like this are to be taken at face value, it is a mistake to think that if a proposition is a priori, it must also be analytic.

Second, belief in certain analytic claims is sometimes justifiable by way of testimony and hence is a posteriori. It is possible (even if atypical) for a person to believe that a cube has six sides because this belief was commended to him by someone he knows to be a highly reliable cognitive agent. Such a belief would be a posteriori since it is presumably by experience that the person has received the testimony of the agent and knows it to be reliable. Thus it is also mistaken to think that if a proposition is a posteriori, it must be synthetic.

Third, there is no principled reason for thinking that every proposition must be knowable. Some analytic and some synthetic propositions may simply be unknowable, at least for cognitive agents like us. We may, for instance, simply be conceptually or constitutionally incapable of grasping the meaning of, or the supporting grounds for, certain propositions. If so, a proposition’s being analytic does not entail that it is a priori, nor does a proposition’s being synthetic entail that it is a posteriori.

This raises the question of the sense in which a claim must be knowable if it is to qualify as either a priori or a posteriori. For whom must such a claim be knowable? Any rational being? Any or most rational human beings? God alone? There may be no entirely nonarbitrary way to provide a very precise answer to this question. Nevertheless, it would seem a mistake to define “knowable” so broadly that a proposition could qualify as either a priori or a posteriori if it were knowable only by a very select group of human beings, or perhaps only by a nonhuman or divine being. And yet, the more narrow the definition of “knowable,” the more likely it is that certain propositions will turn out to be unknowable. “Goldbach’s conjecture” – the claim that every even integer greater than two is the sum of two prime numbers – is sometimes cited as an example of a proposition that may be unknowable by any human being (Kripke 1972).

3. The Necessary/Contingent Distinction

A necessary proposition is one the truth value of which remains constant across all possible worlds. Thus a necessarily true proposition is one that is true in every possible world, and a necessarily false proposition is one that is false in every possible world. By contrast, the truth value of contingent propositions is not fixed across all possible worlds: for any contingent proposition, there is at least one possible world in which it is true and at least one possible world in which it is false.

The necessary/contingent distinction is closely related to the a priori/a posteriori distinction. It is reasonable to expect, for instance, that if a given claim is necessary, it must be knowable only a priori. Sense experience can tell us only about the actual world and hence about what is the case; it can say nothing about what must or must not be the case. Contingent claims, on the other hand, would seem to be knowable only a posteriori, since it is unclear how pure thought or reason could tell us anything about the actual world as compared to other possible worlds.

While closely related, these distinctions are not equivalent. The necessary/contingent distinction is metaphysical: it concerns the modal status of propositions. As such, it is clearly distinct from the a priori/a posteriori distinction, which is epistemological. Therefore, even if the two distinctions were to coincide, they would not be identical.

But there are also reasons for thinking that they do not coincide. Some philosophers have argued that there are contingent a priori truths (Kripke 1972; Kitcher 1980b). An example of such a truth is the proposition that the standard meter bar in Paris is one meter long. This claim appears to be knowable a priori since the bar in question defines the length of a meter. And yet it also seems that there are possible worlds in which this claim would be false (e.g., worlds in which the meter bar is damaged or exposed to extreme heat). Comparable arguments have been offered in defense of the claim that there are necessary a posteriori truths. Take, for example, the proposition that water is H₂O (ibid.). It is conceivable that this proposition is true across all possible worlds, that is, that in every possible world, water has the molecular structure H₂O. But it also appears that this proposition could only be known by empirical means and hence that it is a posteriori. Philosophers disagree about what to make of cases of this sort, but if the above interpretation of them is correct, a proposition’s being a priori does not guarantee that it is necessary, nor does a proposition’s being a posteriori guarantee that it is contingent.

Finally, on the grounds already discussed, there is no obvious reason to deny that certain necessary and certain contingent claims might be unknowable in the relevant sense. If indeed such propositions exist, then the analytic does not coincide with the necessary, nor the synthetic with the contingent.

4. The Relevant Sense of “Experience”

In Section 1 above, it was noted that a posteriori justification is said to derive from experience and a priori justification to be independent of experience. To further clarify this distinction, more must be said about the relevant sense of “experience”.

There is no widely accepted specific characterization of the kind of experience in question. Philosophers instead have had more to say about how not to characterize it. There is broad agreement, for instance, that experience should not be equated with sensory experience, as this would exclude from the sources of a posteriori justification such things as memory and introspection. (It would also exclude, were they to exist, cognitive phenomena like clairvoyance and mental telepathy.) Such exclusions are problematic because most cases of memorial and introspective justification resemble paradigm cases of sensory justification more than they resemble paradigm cases of a priori justification. It would be a mistake, however, to characterize experience so broadly as to include any kind of conscious mental phenomenon or process; even paradigm cases of a priori justification involve experience in this sense. This is suggested by the notion of rational insight, which many philosophers have given a central role in their accounts of a priori justification. These philosophers describe a priori justification as involving a kind of rational “seeing” or perception of the truth or necessity of a priori claims.

There is, however, at least one apparent difference between a priori and a posteriori justification that might be used to delineate the relevant conception of experience (see, e.g., BonJour 1998). In the clearest instances of a posteriori justification, the objects of cognition are features of the actual world which may or may not be present in other possible worlds. Moreover, the relation between these objects and the cognitive states in question is presumably causal. But neither of these conditions would appear to be satisfied in the clearest instances of a priori justification. In such cases, the objects of cognition would appear (at least at first glance) to be abstract entities existing across all possible worlds (e.g., properties and relations). Further, it is unclear how the relation between these objects and the cognitive states in question could be causal. While these differences may seem to point to an adequate basis for characterizing the relevant conception of experience, such a characterization would, as a matter of principle, rule out the possibility of contingent a priori and necessary a posteriori propositions. But since many philosophers have thought that such propositions do exist (or at least might exist), an alternative or revised characterization remains desirable.

All that can be said with much confidence, then, is that an adequate definition of “experience” must be broad enough to include things like introspection and memory, yet sufficiently narrow that putative paradigm instances of a priori justification can indeed be said to be independent of experience.

5. The Relevant Sense of “Independent”

It is also important to examine in more detail the way in which a priori justification is thought to be independent of experience. Here again the standard characterizations are typically negative. There are at least two ways in which a priori justification is often said not to be independent of experience.

The first begins with the observation that before one can be a priori justified in believing a given claim, one must understand that claim. The reasoning for this is that for many a priori claims experience is required to possess the concepts necessary to understand them (Kant 1781). Consider again the claim that if something is red all over then it is not green all over. To understand this proposition, I must have the concepts of red and green, which in turn requires my having had prior visual experiences of these colors.

It would be a mistake, however, to conclude from this that the justification in question is not essentially independent of experience. My actual reason for thinking that the relevant claim is true does not emerge from experience, but rather from pure thought or rational reflection, or from simply thinking about the properties and relations in question. Moreover, the very notion of epistemic justification presupposes that of understanding. In considering whether a person has an epistemic reason to support one of her beliefs, it is simply taken for granted that she understands the believed proposition. Therefore, at most, experience is sometimes a precondition for a priori justification.

Second, many contemporary philosophers accept that a priori justification depends on experience in the negative sense that experience can sometimes undermine or even defeat such justification. This counters the opinions of many historical philosophers who took the position that a priori justification is infallible. Most contemporary philosophers deny such infallibility, but the infallibility of a priori justification does not in itself entail that such justification can be undermined by experience. It is possible that a priori justification is fallible, but that we never, in any particular case, have reason to think it has been undermined by experience. Further, the fallibility of a priori justification is consistent with the possibility that only other instances of a priori justification can undermine or defeat it.

Nonetheless, there would appear to be straightforward cases in which a priori justification might be undermined or overridden by experience. Suppose, for instance, that I am preparing my tax return and add up several numbers in my head. I do this carefully and arrive at a certain sum. Presumably, my belief about this sum is justified and justified a priori. If, however, I decide to check my addition with a calculator and arrive at a different sum, I am quite likely to revise my belief about the original sum and assume that I erred in my initial calculation. It seems clear that my revised belief would be justified and that this justification would be a posteriori, since it is by experience that I am acquainted with what the calculator reads and with the fact that it is a reliable instrument. This is apparently a case in which a priori justification is corrected, and indeed defeated, by experience.

It is important, however, not to overstate the dependence of a priori justification on experience in cases like this, since the initial, positive justification in question is wholly a priori. My original belief in the relevant sum, for example, was based entirely on my mental calculations. It “depended” on experience only in the sense that it was possible for experience to undermine or defeat it. This relation of negative dependence between a priori justification and experience casts little doubt on the view that a priori justification is essentially independent of experience.

6. Positive Characterizations of the A Priori

A priori justification has thus far been defined, negatively, as justification that is independent of experience and, positively, as justification that depends on pure thought or reason. More needs to be said, however, about the positive characterization, both because as it stands it remains less epistemically illuminating than it might and because it is not the only positive characterization available.

How, then, might reason or rational reflection by itself lead a person to think that a particular proposition is true? Traditionally, the most common response to this question has been to appeal to the notion of rational insight. Several historical philosophers (e.g., Descartes 1641; Kant 1781) as well as some contemporary philosophers (e.g., BonJour 1998) have argued that a priori justification should be understood as involving a kind of rational “seeing” or grasping of the truth or necessity of the proposition in question. Consider, for instance, the claim that if Ted is taller than Sandy and Sandy is taller than Louise, then Ted is taller than Louise. Once I consider the meaning of the relevant terms, I seem able to see, in a direct and purely rational way, that if the conjunctive antecedent of this conditional is true, then the conclusion must also be true. According to the traditional conception of a priori justification, my apparent insight into the necessity of this claim justifies my belief in it. Its seeming to me in this clear, immediate, and purely rational way that the claim must be true provides me with a compelling reason for thinking that it is true. Therefore, the following more positive account of a priori justification may be advanced: one is a priori justified in believing a certain claim if one has rational insight into the truth or necessity of that claim.

While phenomenologically plausible and epistemically more illuminating than the previous characterizations, this account of a priori justification is not without difficulties. It would seem, for instance, to require that the objects of rational insight be eternal, abstract, Platonistic entities existing in all possible worlds. If this is the case, however, it becomes very difficult to know what the relation between these entities and our minds might amount to in cases of genuine rational insight (presumably it would not be causal) and whether our minds could reasonably be thought to stand in such a relation (Benacerraf 1973). As a result of this and related concerns, many contemporary philosophers have either denied that there is any a priori justification, or have attempted to offer an account of a priori justification that does not appeal to rational insight.

Accounts of the latter sort come in several varieties. One variety retains the traditional conception of a priori justification requiring the possession of epistemic reasons arrived at on the basis of pure thought or reason, but then claims that such justification is limited to trivial or analytic propositions and therefore does not require an appeal to rational insight (Ayer 1946). A priori justification understood in this way is thought to avoid an appeal to rational insight. The grounds for this claim are that an explanation can be offered of how a person might “see” in a purely rational way that, for example, the predicate concept of a given proposition is contained in the subject concept without attributing to that person anything like an ability to grasp the necessary character of reality. A priori justification is thereby allegedly accounted for in a metaphysically innocuous way.

But views of this kind typically face at least one of two serious objections (BonJour 1998). First, they are difficult to reconcile with what are intuitively the full range of a priori claims. While many a priori claims are analytic, some appear not to be, for instance, the principle of transitivity, the red-green incompatibility case discussed above, as well as several other logical, mathematical, philosophical, and perhaps even moral claims. It is possible, of course, to construe the notion of the analytic so broadly that it apparently does cover such claims, and some accounts of a priori justification have done just this. But this leads immediately to a second and equally troubling objection, namely, that if the claims in question are to be regarded as analytic, it is doubtful that the truth of all analytic claims can be grasped in the absence of anything like rational insight or intuition. Seeing the truth of the claim that seven plus five equals twelve, for instance, does not amount to grasping the definitions of the relevant terms, nor seeing that one concept contains another. Rather, it seems to involve something more substantial and positive, something like an intuitive grasping of the fact that if seven is added to five, the resulting sum must be – cannot possibly fail to be – twelve. But this of course sounds precisely like what the traditional view says is involved with the occurrence of rational insight.

A second alternative to the traditional conception of a priori justification emerges from a general account of epistemic justification that shifts the focus away from the possession of epistemic reasons and onto concepts like epistemic reasonability or responsibility. While presumably closely related to the possession of epistemic reasons, the latter concepts – for reasons discussed below – should not simply be equated with it. On accounts of this sort, one is epistemically justified in believing a given claim if doing so is epistemically reasonable or responsible (e.g., is not in violation of any of one’s epistemic duties).

This model of epistemic justification per se opens the door to an alternative account of a priori justification. It is sometimes argued that belief in many of the principles or propositions that are typically thought to be a priori (e.g., the law of noncontradiction) is in part constitutive of rational thought and discourse. This claim is made on the grounds that without such belief, rational thought and discourse would be impossible. If this argument is compelling, then quite apart from whether we do or even could have any epistemic reasons in support of the claims in question, it would seem we are not violating any epistemic duties, nor behaving in an epistemically unreasonable way, by believing them. Again, the possession of such beliefs is thought to be indispensable to any kind of rational thought or discourse. This yields an account of a priori justification according to which a given claim is justified if belief in it is rationally indispensable in the relevant sense (see, e.g., Boghossian 2000; a view of this sort is also gestured at in Wittgenstein 1969).

While views like this manage to avoid an appeal to the notion of rational insight, they contain at least two serious problems. First, they seem unable to account for the full range of claims ordinarily regarded as a priori. There are arguably a number of a priori mathematical and philosophical claims, for instance, such that belief in them (or in any of the more general claims they might instantiate) is not a necessary condition for rational thought or discourse. Second, these accounts of a priori justification appear susceptible to a serious form of skepticism, for there is no obvious connection between a belief’s being necessary for rational activity and its being true, or likely to be true. Consequently, it seems possible on such a view that a person might be a priori justified in thinking that the belief in question is true and yet have no reason to support it. In fact, given the epistemically foundational character of the beliefs in question, it may be impossible (once an appeal to a priori insight is ruled out) for a person to have any (noncircular) reasons for thinking that any of these beliefs are true. Views of this sort, therefore, appear to have deep skeptical implications.

A third alternative conception of a priori justification shifts the focus toward yet another aspect of cognition. According to externalist accounts of epistemic justification, one can be justified in believing a given claim without having cognitive access to, or awareness of, the factors which ground this justification. Such factors can be “external” to one’s subjective or first-person perspective. (Externalist accounts of justification obviously contrast sharply with accounts of justification that require the possession of epistemic reasons, since the possession of such reasons is a matter of having cognitive access to justifying grounds.) The most popular form of externalism is reliabilism. In broad terms, reliabilists hold that the epistemic justification or warrant for a given belief depends on how, or by what means, this belief was formed. More specifically, they ask whether it was formed by way of a reliable or truth-conducive process or faculty. Thus, according to reliabilist accounts of a priori justification, a person is a priori justified in believing a given claim if this belief was formed by a reliable, nonempirical or nonexperiential belief-forming process or faculty.

Reliabilist accounts of a priori justification face at least two of the difficulties mentioned above in connection with the other nontraditional accounts of a priori justification. First, they seem to allow that a person might be a priori justified in believing a given claim without having any reason for thinking that the claim is true. A person might form a belief in a reliable and nonempirical way, yet have no epistemic reason to support it. Accounts of this sort are therefore also susceptible to a serious form of skepticism. A second problem is that, contrary to the claims of some reliabilists (e.g., Bealer 1999), it is difficult to see how accounts of this sort can avoid appealing to something like the notion of rational insight. There are at least two levels at which this is so. First, the reliabilist must provide a more specific characterization of the cognitive processes or faculties that generate a priori justification. It is not enough simply to claim that these processes or faculties are nonempirical or nonexperiential. This in turn will require a more detailed account of the phenomenology associated with the operation of these processes or faculties. But what would a more detailed account of this phenomenology look like if it did not, in some way, refer to what traditional accounts of a priori justification characterize as rational insight? After all, reliable nonempirical methods of belief formation differ from those that are unreliable, such as sheer guesswork or paranoia, precisely because they involve a reasonable appearance of truth or logical necessity. And it is just this kind of intuitive appearance that is said to be characteristic of rational insight. Thus it appears that in working out some of the details of her account, the reliabilist will be forced to invoke at least the appearance of rational insight. Second, the reliabilist is obliged to shed some light on why the kind of nonempirical cognitive process or faculty in question is reliable. But here again it is difficult to know how to avoid an appeal to rational insight. How else could a given nonempirical cognitive process or faculty lead reliably to the formation of true beliefs if not by virtue of its involving a kind of rational access to the truth or necessity of these beliefs? It is far from clear to what else the reliabilist might plausibly appeal in order to explain the reliability of the relevant kind of process or faculty.

It appears, then, that the most viable reliabilist accounts of a priori justification will, like traditional accounts, make use of the notion of rational insight. Some reliabilist views (e.g., Plantinga 1993) do precisely this by claiming, for instance, that one is a priori justified in believing a given claim if this belief was produced by the faculty of reason, the operation of which involves rational insight into the truth or necessity of the claim in question. The plausibility of a reliabilist account of this sort, vis-à-vis a traditional account, ultimately depends, of course, on the plausibility of the externalist commitment that drives it.

7. References and Further Reading

• Audi, Robert. 1999. “Self-Evidence,” Philosophical Perspectives, vol. 13, ed. James E. Tomberlin (Oxford: Blackwell), pp. 205-28.
• Ayer, A.J. 1946. “The A Priori,” in Language, Truth and Logic, 2nd ed. (New York: Dover), pp. 71-87.
• Bealer, George. 1999. “The A Priori,” in The Blackwell Guide to Epistemology, eds. John Greco and Ernest Sosa (Oxford: Blackwell), pp. 243-70.
• Benacerraf, Paul. 1973. “Mathematical Truth,” The Journal of Philosophy 19: 661-79.
• Boghossian, Paul. 2000. “Knowledge of Logic,” in New Essays on the A Priori (Oxford: Oxford University Press), pp. 229-54.
• BonJour, Laurence. 1998. In Defense of Pure Reason (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press).
• Casullo, Albert. 1992. “A priori/a posteriori,” in A Companion to Epistemology, eds. Jonathan Dancy and Ernest Sosa (Oxford: Blackwell), pp. 1-3.
• Descartes, René. 1641. Meditations on First Philosophy, 3rd ed., trans. D.A. Cress (Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing Company, 1993).
• Hamlyn, D.W. 1967. “A Priori and A Posteriori,” in The Encyclopedia of Philosophy, vol. 1, ed. Paul Edwards (New York: Macmillan Publishing Company & The Free Press), pp. 140-44.
• Kant, Immanuel. 1781. Critique of Pure Reason, trans. N.K. Smith (London: Macmillan, 1929).
• Kitcher, Philip. 1980a. “A Priori Knowledge,” Philosophical Review 89: 3-23.
• Kitcher, Philip. 1980b. “A Priority and Necessity,” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 58: 89-101.
• Kripke, Saul. 1972. Naming and Necessity (Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press).
• Moser, Paul, ed. 1987. A Priori Knowledge (Oxford: Oxford University Press).
• Plantinga, Alvin. 1993. “A Priori Knowledge,” in Warrant and Proper Function (New York: Oxford University Press), pp. 102-21.
• Quine, W.V. 1963. “Two Dogmas of Empiricism,” in From a Logical Point of View, 2nd ed. (New York: Harper and Row), pp. 20-46.
• Wittgenstein, Ludwig. 1969. On Certainty, eds. G.E.M. Anscombe and G.H. von Wright, trans. D. Paul and Anscombe (New York: Harper and Row).

Author Information

Jason S. Baehr
Email: Jbaehr@lmu.edu
Loyola Marymount University
U. S. A.

The KK (Knowing that One Knows) Principle

In its simplest form, the KK principle says that, for any proposition p, if one knows that p, then one knows that one knows it. More complex formulations say that if one knows that p, then one is in a position to know that one knows it, and this is fleshed out in a variety of ways. One reason why philosophers are interested in the KK principle is its relevance to the question of whether epistemic logic is a branch of modal logic. An important issue in modal logic is whether necessary truths are necessarily necessary; the corresponding issue in modal epistemic logic is whether the KK principle holds. Another reason for interest in the principle is its relevance to the debate between internalists and externalists about knowledge. It is natural for internalists to endorse something like the KK principle, and for externalists to reject it. A third reason for interest in the KK principle is its connection to the paradox of the Surprise Examination. The reasoning which generates this paradox seems to assume that certain kinds of knowledge can be repeatedly iterated, and hence that something like the KK principle holds. A final reason for studying the principle is its relevance to recent debates about the luminosity of mental states (where a mental state is luminous iff, roughly, one cannot be in that state without being in a position to know that one is in it). If the KK principle holds, then knowledge is a luminous mental state; but there are powerful arguments against the luminosity of other mental states which seem to show that this cannot be the case.

Table of Contents

1. Hintikka on the KK principle
2. Internalism, Externalism and the KK principle
3. The Surprise Examination and the KK principle
4. Williamson’s Anti-Luminosity Argument
5. Replies to Williamson
6. References and Further Reading

1. Hintikka on the KK principle

In his 1951, G.H. von Wright suggested that epistemic logic— the logic of the term “knows”— is a branch of modal logic— that is to say, the logic of possibility and necessity. Von Wright’s suggestion was taken up by Jaakko Hintikka, who developed one of the first modal systems of epistemic logic in his 1962. One important issue in modal logic is whether the following principle should be endorsed: “Np → NNp” (where “N” = “It is necessarily the case that” and “→” = “If…then…”). The corresponding issue in modal epistemic logic is whether the following principle should be endorsed: “Kp → KKp” (where “K” = “One knows that”). In chapter 5 of his 1962, Hintikka argues that it should.

Hintikka’s arguments for this “KK principle” are hard to follow; but the gist of them (as clarified in his 1970) seems to be this:

Suppose we say that evidence for a proposition, P, is conclusive iff it is so strong that, once one discovers it, further inquiry cannot give one reason to stop believing P. The concept of knowledge used by many philosophers seems to be a strong one on which one knows P only if one’s evidence for P is conclusive in this sense. It is plausible that the KK principle holds for this strong concept of knowledge. For it is plausible that one’s evidence for P is conclusive in the above sense only if it rules out the possibility that one does not know P, and thus only if it allows one to know that one knows P.

To see this, suppose one has evidence, E, for a proposition P, and that E does not rule out the possibility that one does not know P. If E does not rule out this possibility, then, after one has discovered E, further inquiry can, in principle, reveal to one that one does not know P. But if further inquiry were to reveal this, then it would surely give one reason to stop believing P (since one should not believe things that one does not know). So it is plausible that, if E does not rule out the possibility that one does not know P, then it is not conclusive in the sense just defined, and hence plausible that, if knowledge requires evidence that is conclusive in this sense, the KK principle holds. (cf. Hintikka 1970: 145-6)

As Hintikka stresses in his 1970, the above argument aims only to show that the KK principle holds for a very strong, idealised concept of knowledge, which may be very different from the concept used in everyday discourse. Because of this, Hintikka can sidestep objections which say that the principle conflicts with our everyday knowledge claims. One such objection says that, when the claim is made that someone knows that p, it cannot usually be claimed that they know that they know that p, that they know that they know that they know that p, and so on (cf. Rynin 1967: 29). The fact that one is not prepared to claim these things may show that the KK principle fails for our ordinary concept of knowledge, but it does not show that the principle fails for the strong concept that Hintikka has in mind. Similarly, the objection that the KK principle prevents knowledge from being ascribed to animals and young children (who lack the concept of knowledge and so cannot know that they know) is not problematic for Hintikka. For he can say that, when knowledge is ascribed to such subjects, the everyday concept of knowledge is being used rather than his strong concept.

If the KK principle only holds for a concept of knowledge that is very different from our everyday concept, then why should one be interested in it? According to Hintikka, its interest derives from the fact that (in spite of the differences between our everyday concept and the strong concept) there are “many philosophers, traditional as well as contemporary” who use the strong concept of knowledge for which the principle holds (1970: 148). Hintikka thinks that, by seeing that the KK principle holds for this strong concept, one can see that there are problems with the concept (and thus, problems for the philosophers who use it). He argues for this by appealing to some ideas about the purpose of philosophical and scientific inquiry that are suggested by the work of Karl Popper.

According to these Popperian ideas, philosophers and scientists should always aim to encourage inquiry and discussion; they should never try to bring it to an end. Because of this, they should not employ a concept of knowledge which requires conclusive evidence in Hintikka’s sense. For evidence for P which is conclusive in this sense renders further inquiry into P pointless, and so acts as a “discussion stopper.” And what philosophers and scientists should be aiming for is evidence that encourages further inquiry and discussion, rather than evidence that stops it. (Hintikka 1970: 148-9)

Another problem for the strong concept of knowledge which Hintikka mentions briefly is that the standards that one must meet, in order to satisfy this concept, seem unrealistically high (1970: 149). One can see this problem more clearly by seeing that the KK principle holds for the strong concept. For, as shall be seen in section 3, there is reason to think that each iteration of one’s knowledge requires an improvement in one’s epistemic position. Because of this, the KK principle can seem to imply, implausibly, that one must be in a maximally strong epistemic position in order to know.

2. Internalism, Externalism and the KK principle

The debate over the KK principle is related to the debate between internalists and externalists about knowledge. The connection between the two debates can be illustrated by focusing on some examples of internalist and externalist theories.

A good example of an internalist theory of knowledge is the classical “justified true belief” or JTB theory that was the target of Edmund Gettier’s 1963 article. According to the JTB theory, knowledge is true belief that is based on adequate evidence or reasons, where the adequacy of our evidence or reasons is something that one can determine by introspection and reflection.

A good example of an externalist theory of knowledge is the reliabilist theory defended by Goldman (1979) and others on which knowledge is, roughly, true belief that is produced by a reliable process. The reliability of the processes that produce our beliefs is not something that one can determine by introspection and reflection; it is a matter for empirical investigation.

In general, internalist theories of knowledge say that the property which distinguishes knowledge from mere true belief (which property, following Plantinga 1993a, can be called warrant) is internal to our cognitive perspective. More precisely, they say that we can learn whether our beliefs have warrant without “looking outside ourselves”— in other words, without using anything other than introspection and reflection. Externalist theories say that warrant may be external to our cognitive perspective, and that empirical investigation may be needed to ascertain which of our beliefs have it. The reliabilist theory described is just one example of an externalist theory. Others include the causal theory of knowledge defended by Goldman (1967) and the counterfactual theories defended by Dretske (1971) and Nozick (1981).

It is natural for internalists to endorse something like the KK principle. For knowing that one knows that p is primarily a matter of knowing that one’s belief that p is warranted, and it is natural for internalists to say that one is always in a position to know whether one’s beliefs are warranted. Of course, to know that one knows that p, one must also know that one’s belief that p is true. But it seems clear that anyone who knows that p is in a position to know that their belief that p is true; so it is natural for internalists to endorse the KK principle.

It is also natural for externalists to reject this principle. For, if warrant may be external to our cognitive perspective, then there is no special reason to expect those who know that p to be in a position to know that their belief that p is warranted. This can be seen this more clearly by focusing on the reliabilist theory of knowledge. If one’s belief that p is produced by a reliable process that one knows nothing about, then one may have no way of knowing that this belief constitutes knowledge, and thus no way of knowing that one knows that p.

In light of the above points, it is natural to think that arguments for internalist theories of knowledge support the KK principle, and that arguments for externalist theories threaten it. Arguments for externalist theories are given by Goldman (1967, 1976), Armstrong (1973), Dretske (1971, 1981), Nozick (1981) and Plantinga (1993a and 1993b), and arguments for internalist theories by Chisholm (1966, 1988), Lehrer (1974, 1986) and BonJour (1985). Externalist theories are often motivated by a desire to understand knowledge in terms of scientific concepts, like causation and counterfactual dependence (cf. Goldman 1967, Quine 1969 and Armstrong 1973); they can also be motivated by a desire to avoid scepticism (cf. Nozick 1981). Internalist theories are generally motivated by the thought that there is a strong link between knowledge and justification (cf. Chisholm 1966, Lehrer 1974 and BonJour 1985); they can also be motivated by the related thought that knowledge is an essentially normative property (cf. BonJour 1985, Chisholm 1988 and Kim 1988). Whether these motivations for the two kinds of theory are good ones remains to be seen; but it is useful to see that they have a bearing not just on these theories, but also on the issue of whether the KK principle holds.

However, it is important to realise that, while it is natural for internalists to endorse and externalists to reject the KK principle, it is not necessary for them to do so. Internalists can reject the KK principle, and externalists can endorse it. To see that internalists can reject the KK principle, note that it is possible to adopt a position on which one is not always in a position to know about the internal, mental properties that are normally accessible to introspection and reflection. Timothy Williamson holds a position of this kind; his arguments for it are described in section 4. To see that externalists can endorse the KK principle, note that one can say that the property that externalists identify with warrant— such as being caused in the right way, or being produced by a reliable process— is one that has to be known about in order to have knowledge. Alvin Goldman comes close to adopting a position of this kind in his 1967, when he argues that, in cases of inferential knowledge, a subject must “correctly reconstruct” important elements of the causal chain leading from the fact that p to their belief that p in order to have knowledge.

Overall, it seems clear that, while the internalism/externalism debate is relevant to the KK principle, there are other issues that bear on its status. Some of these issues are described in the next two sections.

3. The Surprise Examination and the KK principle

There are a number of thinkers who hold that the KK principle, or something very like it, plays a crucial role in the Surprise Examination paradox (see Harrison 1969, McLelland and Chihara 1975 and Williamson 1992: 226-32 and 2000:135-146 for examples). Their view is, roughly, that the paradox can be solved by rejecting the principle. In what follows, a brief outline will be given of the paradox and the way in which the principle seems to be related to it. (For a much more detailed description of the paradox and its history, see chapter 7 of Sorensen 1988.)

Suppose that a teacher announces to her pupils that she intends to give them a surprise examination at some point in the following term. The pupils can argue, as follows, that she will not be able to do this:

If you want the exam to be a surprise, then you cannot give it on the last day of term; for if you do, then we will know, on the second-to-last day, that it will be on the last day, and the exam won’t be a surprise. You also cannot give the exam on the second-to-last day of term. For if you do, then we will know, on the third-to-last day, that it will be on either the last day or the second-to-last day, and will know, by the reasoning just described, that it will not be on the last day; so again the exam won’t be a surprise. Parallel reasoning shows that you cannot give the exam on the third-to-last day, or the fourth-to-last day, or on any of the other days of term. Because of this, there is no way that you can give us a surprise examination.

It is natural to think there must be something wrong with the pupils’ reasoning; but it is hard to see where the reasoning goes wrong. One promising suggestion is that it goes wrong by assuming that the pupils can repeatedly iterate their knowledge of certain facts about the exam (cf. Williamson 2000: 140-1). To see that this suggestion is promising, the pupils’ reasoning needs to be divided into parts.

Let part 1 of the pupils’ reasoning be the part that rules out the last day, let part 2 be the part that rules out the second-to-last day, and so on. Since part 2 of the pupils’ reasoning rests on the assumption that part 1 works, it is natural to say that part 2 works only if they know that part 1 works. And since part 3 rests on the assumption that part 2 works, it is natural to say that part 3 works only if they know that part 2 works, and thus, only if they are in a position to know that they know that part 1 works. Similar reasoning seems to show that part 4 works only if they are in a position to know that they know that they know that part 1 works, and so on. So the pupils’ reasoning seems to assume that they are in a position to repeatedly iterate their knowledge of the fact that part 1 works, and it is not at all clear that this assumption is correct.

To see that the assumption is implausible, imagine that the teacher asks the pupils whether they know that part 1 of their reasoning works, and then asks them whether they know that they know this, and so on. It is plausible that, at some stage of this interrogation, the pupils should stop saying “Yes” to the teacher’s questions. For it is plausible that the epistemic standard that the pupils have to meet in order to appropriately say “Yes” goes up with each new question. If someone is asked whether it is the case that p, and when they say “Yes,” they are asked whether they know that it is the case that p, they are generally being asked to check their original assertion against higher standards (cf. DeRose 2002: 184-5).

Because of this, it is plausible that the pupils cannot go on iterating their knowledge of part 1’s success forever. And if that is so, then there is a limit to the number of possible examination days that their reasoning can rule out. If there is such a limit, it can be used to explain why the pupils’ reasoning fails to show that the teacher cannot give them a surprise examination. The explanation is that they cannot iterate their knowledge of part 1’s success enough to rule out every day of the term.

In defense of this explanation, note that the pupils’ reasoning does seem to rule out later days of the term as possible days for the exam. It is very plausible that part 1 of the reasoning rules out the last day of term as a possible date for the exam, and quite plausible that part 2 rules out the second-to-last day. But parts 3 and 4 seem more questionable, and by the time part 10 is gotten to, it is clear that something has gone wrong. The above explanation can account for this gradual loss of power in the pupils’ reasoning, by appealing to the gradual increase in the number of iterations of knowledge required to make the reasoning work (cf. Williamson 2000: 142).

If the failure of the pupils’ reasoning is best explained in terms of limits on their ability to iterate their knowledge, then one seems obliged to say that their knowledge does not satisfy the KK principle. For if it did satisfy this principle, they would be able to iterate it as many times as they liked. The fact that the knowledge of the epistemically limited pupils does not satisfy this principle does not show that there are not other, more idealised kinds of knowledge that do. But it does suggest that the principle fails to hold for our everyday concept of knowledge, and hence that the best strategy for defending it is to follow Hintikka in arguing that it holds only for a strengthened version of this concept.

4. Williamson’s Anti-Luminosity Argument

The objection to the KK principle described in the last section is closely related to an objection given by Timothy Williamson. Williamson’s objection uses the concept of luminosity; for him, a condition, C, is luminous iff the following claim holds:

(L) For every case α, if in α C obtains, then in α one is in a position to know that C obtains (2000: 95).

If the KK principle holds, then the condition of knowing that p is luminous in Williamson’s sense. In chapter 4 of his 2000, Williamson argues that any condition that can be gradually gained or lost is not luminous, and that, since knowing that p is a condition that can be gradually gained or lost, the KK principle fails.

Williamson argues against the luminosity of conditions that can be gradually gained or lost by focusing on the condition of feeling cold, which seems to stand a very good chance of being luminous. His argument is focused on a case in which:

(i) One feels freezing cold at dawn, very slowly warms up and feels hot by noon.

(ii) One is not aware of any change in one’s feelings of hot and cold over 1 millisecond, and:

(iii) Throughout the morning, one thoroughly considers how cold or hot one feels, and so always knows everything that one is in a position to know about this.

Using t₀, t₁… t_n for times at 1 millisecond intervals between dawn and noon, and α_i for the case that holds at t_i (where 0 ≤ i ≤ n), Williamson argues that the following principle holds for all values of i:

(1_i) If in α_i one knows that one feels cold, then in α_i+1 one feels cold.

He does so by appealing to the plausible safety principle that, if one knows that p, then one’s belief that p could not easily have been false. When this principle is formulated in terms of possible cases, it says: one knows that p in case α only if one’s belief that p is true in every possible case that is sufficiently similar to α. Since α_i+1 is extremely similar to α_i for every value of i, it is natural to infer from this principle that (1_i) holds for all such values.

After arguing that (1_i) holds for all such values, Williamson points out that, if feeling cold is luminous, then this principle holds for all values of i:

(2_i) If in α_i one feels cold, then in α_i one knows that one feels cold. (2000: 97)

He then attacks the luminosity of feeling cold by giving a reductio argument against the assumption that (1_i) and (2_i) hold for all values of i. One way of giving this argument (used in Neta and Rohrbaugh 2004) is to note that, by hypothetical syllogism, (2_i) and (1_i) together entail:

(3_i) If in α_i one feels cold, then in α _i+1 one feels cold.

If (1_i) and (2_i) hold for all values of i, then (3_i) also holds for all such values. And if it does, then this principle, which is clearly true:

(4₀) In α₀ one feels cold.

(since α₀ is at dawn and at dawn one is freezing) implies this principle, which is clearly false:

(4_n) In α_n one feels cold.

(since α_n is at noon and at noon one is hot). No true principle can imply a false principle. So (3_i) cannot hold for all values of i, which means that (1_i) and (2_i) cannot hold for all such values. It has been argued that (1_i) holds for all such values; so it seems that (2_i) must fail to hold for some of them. But if feeling cold were luminous then (2_i) would hold for all values of i. So it seems that feeling cold cannot be luminous.

If the above argument shows that the condition of feeling cold is not luminous, then parallel arguments will show the same thing for every condition that can be gradually gained or lost. Since the condition of knowing that p seems to be a condition of this kind, the above argument threatens to show that it is not luminous, and hence that the KK principle fails. But there are ways in which advocates of the KK principle, or of luminosity more generally, can respond to the argument. The next section describes two responses of this kind.

5. Replies to Williamson

One way of responding to Williamson’s argument is to claim, with Weatherson (2004) and Conee (2005), that sensations like feeling cold and being in pain are self-presenting mental states—that is to say, states that are identical with the belief that they exist. If a state is self-presenting, then the belief that it exists satisfies Williamson’s safety constraint; so if feeling cold is self-presenting, then Williamson’s defense of (1_i) fails. However it seems clear that the state of knowing that p is not a self-presenting mental state; for one can believe that one knows that p without actually knowing it. So while this line of response may show that states like feeling cold and being in pain can be luminous, it seems unlikely to save the KK principle (as Weatherson and Conee both grant).

Another way of responding to Williamson’s argument is to claim, with Brueckner and Fiocco (2002) and Neta and Rohrbaugh (2004), that the safety principle to which Williamson appeals is false. This line of response seems more likely to save the KK principle; one way of developing it is to focus on the following example (taken from Neta and Rohrbaugh):

“I am drinking a glass of water which I have just poured from the bottle. Standing next to me is a happy person who has just won the lottery. Had this person lost the lottery, she would have maliciously polluted my water with a tasteless, odorless, colorless toxin. But since she won the lottery, she does no such thing. Nonetheless, she almost lost the lottery. Now, I drink the pure, unadulterated water, and judge, truly and knowingly, that I am drinking pure, unadulterated water. But the toxin would not have flavored the water, and so had the toxin gone in, I would still have believed falsely that I was drinking pure, unadulterated water. The actual case and the envisaged possible case are extremely similar in all past and present phenomenological and physical respects, as well as nomologically indistinguishable. (Furthermore, we can stipulate that, in each case, I am killed by a sniper a few minutes after drinking the water, and so the cases do not differ in future respects.)” [Neta and Rohrbaugh 2004: 400]

It seems clear that, in this example, I know that I am drinking unadulterated water, despite the fact that there is a very similar possible case in which I falsely believe that I am drinking such water. So the example conflicts with the safety principle’s claim that beliefs constitute knowledge only if they are true in all sufficiently similar cases.

Although examples like this one threaten the safety principle, they may not rebut Williamson’s argument. For the key premise of the argument— that (1_i) is true for all values of i— can be defended in other ways. To see this, consider the following claim, which is the contrapositive of (1_i):

(1_i‘) If in α_i+1 one does not feel cold, then in α_i one does not know that one feels cold.

It is plausible independently of the safety principle that (1_i‘), and thus (1_i), holds for all values of i. For if one does not feel cold in α_i+1 and one is not aware of any change in ones feelings of hot and cold between α_i and α_i+1, then how could one possibly know that in α_i one feels cold?

Even if it turns out that (1_i) cannot be adequately defended, it may still turn out that the KK principle is rebutted by reasoning like Williamson’s. For it is possible to give an argument against the KK principle which closely resembles the anti-luminosity argument described above, but which does not appeal to (1_i). This argument focuses on cases of inexact knowledge— that is to say, of the sort of knowledge that one gains by looking at a distant tree and estimating its height, or by looking at a crowd and estimating the number of people that it contains. In chapter 5 of his 2000, Williamson argues that such knowledge satisfies margin for error principles like the following:

(M₁) If I know that the tree is not n inches tall, then it is not n+1 inches tall.

(M₂) If I know that there are not n people in the crowd, then there are not n+1 people in the crowd.

He then shows that, when principles of this kind are conjoined with a plausible closure principle on knowledge, they are incompatible with the KK principle.

Although Williamson’s arguments against the KK principle are powerful, they can be resisted at a price. For, in all of their forms, they assume that some true beliefs constitute knowledge (such as a freezing cold person’s belief that they feel cold) and that others do not (such as an accidentally true belief that a 600-inch-tall distant tree is not 599 inches tall). The first of these assumptions can be denied by endorsing a skeptical theory on which no true belief constitutes knowledge and the second can be denied by endorsing a “universalist” theory on which every true belief constitutes knowledge. Although both theories have implausible consequences, recent work (such as Goldman 2002: 164 on weak senses of knowledge and Hawthorne 2004: 113-141 on skepticism) has revealed that both have attractive features. If the benefits of these theories outweigh their costs, then Williamson’s arguments against the KK principle may still fail. In any case, it seems fair to conclude that the KK principle, and the arguments for and against it, remain important subjects of philosophical debate.

6. References and Further Reading

• Armstrong, D.M. 1973. Belief, Truth and Knowledge. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• BonJour, L. 1985. The Structure of Empirical Knowledge. Cambridge, Mass.: Harvard University Press.
• Brueckner, A. and Fiocco, M.O. 2002. “Williamson’s Anti-Luminosity Argument,” Philosophical Studies 110: 285-293.
• Castaneda, H.N. 1970. “On Knowing (Or Believing) That One Knows (Or Believes),” Synthese 21: 187-203.
• Chisholm, R. 1966. Theory of Knowledge. Englewood Cliffs: Prentice-Hall.
• Chisholm, R. 1988. “The Indispensability of Internal Justification,” Synthese 74: 285-96.
• Conee, E. 2005. “The Comforts of Home,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 70: 444-451.
• Craig, E.J. 1990. Knowledge and the State of Nature. Oxford: Clarenden Press.
• Danto, A.C. 1967. “On Knowing That We Know,” in A. Stroll ed., Epistemology, New York: Harper and Rowe, pp.32-53.
• DeRose, K. 2002. “Assertion, Knowledge and Context,” Philosophical Review 111: 167-203.
• Dretske, F. 1971. “Conclusive Reasons,” Australasian Journal of Philosophy, 49: 1-22.
• Dretske 1981. Knowledge and the Flow of Information. Oxford: Blackwell.
• Gettier, E. 1963. “Is Justified True Belief Knowledge?” Analysis 23: 121-3.
• Ginet, C. 1970. “What Must Be Added to Knowing to Obtain Knowing that One Knows?” Synthese 21: 163-86.
• Goldman 1967. “A Causal Theory of Knowing,” Journal of Philosophy 64: 357-72.
• Goldman 1976. “Discrimination and Perceptual Knowledge,” Journal of Philosophy 73: 771-91.
• Goldman 1979. “What is Justified Belief?” In Justification and Knowledge: New Studies in Epistemology, ed. George Pappas (Dordrecth, D. Reidel, 1979).
• Goldman 2002. Pathways to Knowledge. New York: Oxford.
• Harrison, C, 1969. “The Unanticipated Examination in View of Kripke’s Semantics for Modal Logic,” In J.W. Davies, D.J. Hockney and W.K Wilson eds, Philosophical Logic (Dordrecht: Reidel).
• Hawthorne, J. 2004. Knowledge and Lotteries. New York: Oxford University Press.
• Hintikka, J. 1962. Knowledge and Belief. Ithaca, N.Y.: Cornell University Press.
• Hintikka, J. 1970. “Knowing that One Knows” reviewed. Synthese 21: 141-62.
• Kim, J. 1988. “What is Naturalized Epistemology?” in J.E. Tomberlin ed., Philosophical Perspectives 2: Epistemology (Atascadero/CA: Ridgeview Publishing Co.), pp.381-405.
• Lehrer 1970. “Believing that One Knows,” Synthese 21: 133-40.
• Lehrer 1974. Knowledge. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
• Lehrer 1985. “The Coherence Theory of Knowledge,” Philosophical Topics 14: 5-25.
• Lemmon, E.J. 1967. “If I Know, Do I Know that I Know?” in A. Stroll ed., Epistemology, New York: Harper and Rowe, pp.54-83.
• McLelland, J. and Chihara, C. 1975. “The Surprise Examination Paradox,” Journal of Philosophical Logic 4: 71-89.
• Neta, R. and Rohrbaugh, G. 2004. “Luminosity and the Safety of Knowledge,” Pacific Philosophical Quarterly 85: 396-406.
• Nozick, R. 1981. Philosophical Explanations. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Plantinga, A. 1993a. Warrant: The Current Debate. New York: Oxford University Press.
• Plantinga, A. 1993b. Warrant and Proper Function. New York: Oxford University Press.
• Quine, W.V.O. 1969. “Epistemology Naturalized,” in his Ontological Relativity and Other Essays. New York: Columbia University Press.
• Rynin, D. 1967. “Knowledge, Sensation and Certainty,” in A. Stroll ed., Epistemology, New York: Harper and Rowe, pp.8-32.
• Sorensen, R.A. 1988. Blindspots. New York: Oxford University Press.
• Unger, P. 1975. Ignorance: A Case for Scepticism. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Von Wright, G. 1951. An Essay in Modal Logic. Amsterdam: North-Holland Publishing Co.
• Weatherson, B. 2004. “Luminous Margins,” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 82: 373-83.
• Williamson, T. 1992. “Inexact Knowledge,” Mind, 101: 217-42.
• Williamson, T. 2000. Knowledge and its Limits. New York: Oxford University Press.

Author Information

David Hemp
Email: david_hemp@hotmail.com
Ireland

Coherentism in Epistemology

Coherentism is a theory of epistemic justification. It implies that for a belief to be justified it must belong to a coherent system of beliefs. For a system of beliefs to be coherent, the beliefs that make up that system must “cohere” with one another. Typically, this coherence is taken to involve three components: logical consistency, explanatory relations, and various inductive (non-explanatory) relations. Rival versions of coherentism spell out these relations in different ways. They also differ on the exact role of coherence in justifying beliefs: in some versions, coherence is necessary and sufficient for justification, but in others it is only necessary.

This article reviews coherentism’s history beginning in the last quarter of the twentieth century, and it marks off coherentism from other theses. The regress argument is the dominant anti-coherentist argument, and it bears on whether coherentism or its chief rival, foundationalism, is correct. Several coherentist responses to this argument will be examined. A taxonomy of the many versions of coherentism is presented and followed by the main arguments for and against coherentism. After these arguments, which make up the main body of the article, a final section considers the future prospects of coherentism.

Table of Contents

1. Introduction
   1. History
   2. Describing Coherentism
2. The Regress Argument
   1. The Argument
   2. Coherentist Responses
3. Taxonomy of Coherentist Positions
   1. What is it to Belong to a Belief System?
   2. What is the Makeup of the Coherence Relation?
      1. The Propositional Relation: Deductive Relations
      2. The Propositional Relation: Inductive Relations
      3. The Propositional Relation: Explanatory Relations
      4. The Psychological Realization Condition
4. Arguments for Coherentism
   1. For Sufficiency: The Argument from Increased Probability
   2. For Necessity: Only Beliefs can Justify Other Beliefs
   3. For Necessity: The Need for Justified Background Beliefs
   4. For Necessity: The Need for Meta-Beliefs
5. Arguments Against Coherentism
   1. Against Sufficiency: The Input and Isolation Arguments
   2. Against Sufficiency: The Alternative Coherent Systems Argument
   3. Against Necessity: Feasibility Problems
   4. Against Necessity: The Preface Paradox
   5. Against Necessity: Counterexamples
6. Looking Ahead
7. References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

a. History

British Idealists such as F.H. Bradley (1846-1924) and Bernard Bosanquet (1848-1923) championed coherentism. So, too, did the philosophers of science Otto Neurath (1882-1945), Carl Hempel (1905-1997), and W.V. Quine (1908-2000). However, it is a group of contemporary epistemologists that has done the most to develop and defend coherentism: most notably Laurence BonJour in The Structure of Empirical Knowledge (1985) and Keith Lehrer in Knowledge (1974) and Theory of Knowledge (1990), but also Gilbert Harman, William Lycan, Nicholas Rescher, and Wilfrid Sellars. Despite this long list of names, coherentism is a minority position among epistemologists. It is probably only in moral epistemology that coherentism enjoys wide acceptance. Under the influence of a prominent interpretation of John Rawls’s model of wide reflective equilibrium, many moral philosophers have opted for a coherentist view of what justifies moral beliefs.

b. Describing Coherentism

Epistemological coherentism (or simply “coherentism”) needs to be distinguished from several other theses. Because it is not a theory of truth, coherentism is not the coherence theory of truth. That theory says that a proposition is true just in case it coheres with a set of propositions. This theory of truth has fallen out of favor in large part because it is thought to be too permissive – an obviously false proposition such as I am a coffee cup coheres with this set of propositions: I am not a human, I am in the kitchen cupboard, I weigh 7 ounces. Even contemporary defenders of coherentism are usually quick to distance themselves from this theory of truth.

Coherentism is also distinct from a thesis about concepts that sometimes goes under the name “concept holism.” Roughly, this thesis says that possessing a particular concept requires possessing a number of other concepts: for example, possessing the concept of assassination requires also having the concepts of killing and death. Concepts, according to the thesis of holism, do not come individually, but in packages. What is crucial here is that neither concept holism nor the coherence theory of truth say anything about the conditions under which a belief is justified.

So exactly what does coherentism have to say regarding when our beliefs are justified? The strongest form of coherentism says that belonging to a coherent system of beliefs is

1. necessary for a belief to be justified and
2. by itself sufficient for a belief to be justified.

This view—call it strong coherentism—can be contrasted with two weaker varieties of coherentism. Necessity coherentism just makes the necessity claim at (1). It imposes coherence as what is often called “a structural condition” on justification. Structural conditions just tell us how beliefs must be related to one another if they are to be justified. However, being related to one another in the required way may not suffice for justification, since there might be additional non-structural conditions on justified belief. A particularly lucid statement of necessity coherentism can be found in the 1992 paper by Kvanvig and Riggs. By contrast, strong coherentism can be thought of as denying that there are any non-structural conditions.

When thinking about strong coherentism, it is important to appreciate the by itself qualification in (2). This qualification sets coherentism off from one of its most important rivals. The rival view is typically classified as non-coherentist, but it still gives coherence a supplemental role in justifying beliefs. This view claims that coherence can boost the justification of a belief as long as that belief is already independently justified in some way that is not due to coherence. On this sort of view, coherence is sufficient to boost beliefs that are independently justified. This, however, is not thought to be strong enough to deserve the “coherentist” label. To make coherence sufficient for justification in a way that deserves the label, one must claim that coherence is sufficient, by itself, to generate justification – in other words, coherence must generate justification from scratch. Call this sufficiency coherentism. Notice, also, that sufficiency coherentism allows other factors besides coherence to be sufficient for justification.

Another role that non-coherentists sometimes give to coherence comes in a negative condition on epistemic justification. This condition says that incoherent beliefs fail to be justified. It might seem that on this view, coherence is necessary for justification. But this only follows if coherence and incoherence are contradictories. Below, we will see reasons to think that they are not contradictories, but instead contraries. This explains why a view that says that incoherence disqualifies beliefs from being justified is not classified as a coherentist view. More is required to get the claim that coherence is necessary for justification.

There are real difficulties for circumscribing self-styled coherentists. Not every self-styled coherentist subscribes to either (1) or (2). For example, BonJour, in his 1985 book, held that meeting the coherence condition is not sufficient for justification, since he claimed that, in addition, justified beliefs must meet a distinctive internalist condition. Moreover, since BonJour also held (and still holds) that coherence is not necessary for the justification of a priori beliefs, strictly speaking he did not hold that coherence is necessary for epistemic justification either. Still his early view should be classified as coherentist, since he claimed that coherence is a necessary condition on a wide class of beliefs’ being justified, namely empirical beliefs.

In what follows, each argument for coherentism will be classified according to whether it aims to show necessity coherentism, or sufficiency coherentism (this will also cover arguments for strong coherentism, since it is simply the conjunction of necessity coherentism and sufficiency coherentism). Similarly, each argument against coherentism will be classified according to whether it targets necessity coherentism, or sufficiency coherentism (since an argument that targets either of these views is also an argument against strong coherentism, this will cover arguments against strong coherentism). Following BonJour and much of the recent literature, the focus will be on our empirical beliefs and whether there is a coherence condition on the justification of these beliefs.

One more preliminary point is in order. Since necessity coherentism just makes a claim about the structure that our justified beliefs must take, it is neutral on whether coherence must be introspectively accessible if it is to function as a justifier. In other words, it is neutral on the debate between epistemic internalism and epistemic externalism. So while the most important recent coherentists – namely Laurence BonJour (1985) and Keith Lehrer (1974 and 1990) – have also espoused epistemological internalism, this commitment is over and above that of structural coherentism. This makes their views incompatible with strong coherentism, since the internalist commitment is an additional condition over and above that of structural coherentism.

2. The Regress Argument

The Regress Argument goes back at least as far as Aristotle’s Prior Analytics, Book 1. Like many others, Aristotle takes it to support coherentism’s chief rival, foundationalism. The argument has two stages: one that identifies all of the candidate structural conditions; and one that rules against the coherentist candidate.

a. The Argument

The argument opens with the claim that some of a person’s justified beliefs are justified because they derive their justification from other beliefs. For example, take my justified belief that tomorrow is Wednesday. That belief is justified by two other beliefs: my belief that today is Tuesday and my belief that Tuesday is immediately followed by Wednesday. But, if my belief that tomorrow is Wednesday derives its justification from these other beliefs, then my belief that tomorrow is Wednesday is justified only if these other beliefs are justified. Consider these other beliefs. One possibility is that they derive their justification from yet further beliefs, in which case they are dependent for their justification on those further beliefs – if it is, we can shift our attention to these further beliefs. The other possibility is that these beliefs are justified, but their justification does not derive from some other justified beliefs.

Three options emerge. According to the foundationalist option, the series of beliefs terminates with special justified beliefs called “basic beliefs”: these beliefs do not owe their justification to any other beliefs from which they are inferred. According to the infinitist option, the series of relations wherein one belief derives its justification from one or more other beliefs goes on without either terminating or circling back on itself. According to one construal of the coherentist option, the series of beliefs does circle back on itself, so that it includes, once again, previous beliefs in the series.

Standard presentations of the Regress Argument are used to establish foundationalism; to this end, they include further arguments against the infinitist and coherentist options. These arguments are the focus of the second stage. Let’s focus on the two most popular arguments against coherentism which figure into the Regress Argument; and let’s continue to construe coherentism as saying that beliefs are justified in virtue of forming a circle. The first argument makes a circularity charge. By opting for a closed loop, the charge is that coherentism certifies circular reasoning. A necessity coherentist will be charged with making circular reasoning necessary for justified belief. A sufficiency coherentist will be charged with making circular reasoning part of something (namely, coherence) that is sufficient for justified belief. But circular reasoning is an epistemic flaw, not an epistemic virtue. It is neither necessary, nor part of what is sufficient, for justified belief; in fact, it precludes justified belief.

The second argument takes aim at the claim that coherence is necessary for justification. Since a belief is justified only if, through a chain of other beliefs, we ultimately return to the original belief, coherentism is committed, despite the initial appearance, to the claim that the original belief is justified, at least in part, by itself. This is supposed to follow from the coherentist corollary that if the chain of supporting beliefs did not eventually double back on the original belief, then the original belief would not be justified. But the claim that my belief that tomorrow is Wednesday is justified (even in part) by itself is mistaken – after all, it is derived, via inference, from other beliefs. Call this, the self-support charge.

b. Coherentist Responses

Coherentists need not resist the first stage of the regress argument since that stage, recall, just generated the candidate views. Their responses focus on the second stage. That coherentism is the best of the three candidates is argued for in several ways: by highlighting shortcomings with infinitism and foundationalism, by giving positive arguments for coherentism (we will look at these later in Section 4), and by responding to objections against coherentism. Let’s continue with the two objections that have already been tabled, the circularity and self-support objections, and examine some coherentist responses to these objections.

Some coherentists have responded to the circularity charge by suggesting that reasoning in a circle is not a problem as long as the circle is large enough. This suggestion has not found much favor. What is worrisome about circular reasoning, for example, that it is overly permissive since it allows one to easily construct reasons for any claim whatsoever, applies just as well to large circles of beliefs.

According to a more instructive reply, the circularity charge and the self-support charge rest on a misconception about coherentism. Often coherentists point out that their view is that systems of beliefs are what is, in the first place, justified (or unjustified). Individual beliefs are not the items that are primarily justified (or unjustified). Put in this light, the whole approach of the regress argument is question begging. For notice the argument had us begin with an individual belief that was justified, though conditionally so. Then we went in search of what justifies that belief. This “linear” approach to justification led to the circularity and self-support charges. Coherentism, however, proposes a “holistic” view of justification. On this kind of view, the primary bearer of epistemic justification is a system of beliefs. Seen in this light, both charges seem to be question begging.

Some have argued that the move to holistic justification fails to really answer the circularity and self-support charges. For even granting that it is a system of beliefs that is primarily justified, it is still true that a system of beliefs is justified in virtue of the fact that the individual beliefs that make up the system relate to one another in a circular fashion. And it is still true that a belief must support itself if it is to be justified, since this is needed if the relevant system of beliefs (and hence the individual belief) is to be justified. It is not so clear, then, that the reply which highlights the holistic nature of justification is successful.

However, by conjoining the appeal to epistemic holism with another appeal, a coherentist might have a fully satisfactory reply. This second appeal identifies another misconception about coherentism that might lie behind the circularity charge and the self-support charge. This misconception has to do with the variety of ways in which our beliefs can support one another so that they come out justified. Coherentists are fond of metaphors like rafts, webs, and bricks in an arch. These things stay together because their parts support one another. Each part both supports, and is supported by, other specific parts. So too with justified beliefs: each is both supported by, and supports, other beliefs. This means that among support relations, there are symmetrical support relations: one belief can support a second (perhaps mediately through other beliefs), while the second also supports the first (again, perhaps, mediately). Beliefs that stand in sufficiently strong support relations to one another are coherent, and therefore justified.

This contrasts with foundationalism’s trademark bifurcation of beliefs into basic beliefs and non-basic beliefs. Basic beliefs do the supporting; non-basic beliefs are what they support. According to foundationalists, there are no symmetrical support relations. This much is clear enough. The delicate issue that it raises is this: do the circularity and self-support charges rest on an assumption that beliefs cannot be justified in virtue of standing in symmetrical support relations to one another? If the charges require this assumption, then they might beg the question.

Consider the circularity charge first. To simply assert that circular reasoning is epistemically defective and therefore cannot generate justified beliefs seems very close to simply asserting that beliefs cannot be justified in virtue of standing in symmetrical support relations. What the opponent of coherentism must do is tell us more precisely why circular reasoning is epistemically defective. While the considerations they call on might well imply that symmetrical support relations do not justify, they will be ineffective if they simply assume this.

We are now in a position to see that the self-support charge is importantly different from the circularity charge. Where the circularity charge targets the coherentist claim that beliefs are justified by standing in support relations that are mediated by other beliefs but ultimately return to themselves, the self-support charge focuses on an alleged implication of this, namely that beliefs are therefore justified at least in part because they stand in support relations to themselves. In slogan form: reflexive relations justify.

So what about the self-support charge? Does making this charge require assuming that symmetrical support relations cannot justify? We need to be careful. While the claim that the support relation is transitive and the claim that supporting relations link back to a previously linked belief implies that the relevant belief supports itself, coherentists are not thereby stuck with the claim that this belief is justified in virtue of supporting itself. Arguably, it is open to the coherentist to hold, instead, that this belief is justified in virtue of the circular structure of the support relations, while denying that it is justified in virtue of supporting itself. Still, this may not be enough, since the coherentist might still have to maintain that justified belief is compatible with self-support.

3. Taxonomy of Coherentist Positions

Recall that strong coherentism says S’s belief that p is justified if and only if it belongs, and coheres with, a system of S’s beliefs, and this system is coherent. Central to this formulation are three notions: the notion of a system of beliefs, the notion of belonging to a system of beliefs, and the notion of a coherent system of beliefs. Let’s look at these in order. As we will see, each can be spelled out in different ways. The result is that coherentism covers a wide variety of views.

a. What is it to Belong to a Belief System?

What qualifies a set of beliefs as a system of beliefs? Partly, it is the number of beliefs that make it up. Minimally, a system of beliefs must consist in at least two beliefs. In a moment, we will see that two is probably not enough. The other extreme – that the size of the relevant system is one’s entire corpus of beliefs – must be rejected, on the grounds that any sufficiently strong incoherence would make all of one’s beliefs unjustified. This is implausible, since incoherence in one’s outlook on one topic, say set theory, should not affect the epistemic status of one’s outlook on an unconnected topic, say whether one is presently in pain. Between these two extremes lie a number of importantly different intermediate positions. There are a few general approaches to carving out distinct systems of beliefs in a belief corpus. Let’s look at four.

One way of individuating systems of beliefs is by reference to their subject-matters. For example, your beliefs about mathematical matters might form one system of beliefs, while your beliefs about tonight’s dinner might form another. Alternatively, systems of beliefs might be individuated by the sources that produced them: visual beliefs might form one system, auditory beliefs another, memorial beliefs another, and so forth. The third possibility involves individuating systems phenomenologically. Beliefs themselves, or perhaps key episodes that come with acquiring them, might have phenomenological markers. If these markers stand in similarity relations to one another, this would lead to grouping beliefs into distinct systems. A final possibility, perhaps the most plausible one, involves individuating systems of beliefs according to whether the beliefs that belong to a particular system stand in some dependency relations of a psychological sort to one another – for example, a psychological relation like that involved in inference. We will return to this fourth possibility below.

Let’s turn to the second notion, that of belonging to a system of beliefs. According to straightforward accounts of this notion, for a belief to belong to a system of beliefs, it must relate to the beliefs that make up that system in just the same way that the beliefs relate to one another if they are to constitute a system of beliefs. This will involve one of the four possibilities that were just surveyed.

b. What is the Makeup of the Coherence Relation?

Coherence relations can hold among a set of beliefs that constitute a system. Arguably, coherence relations can also hold between systems of beliefs. On the simplest view, the latter occurs when the individual beliefs that are members of the respective systems cohere with one another across systems. As a result, the beliefs belonging to the respective systems gain in justification. Here, I will focus on the easier case in which a set of beliefs constitute a single coherent system of beliefs.

A coherent system of beliefs has two basic marks. First, the beliefs have to have propositional contents which relate to one another in some specified way. Call this the propositional relation. Additionally, it is plausible to think that the relevant beliefs must be related to one another in one’s psychology in some way, for example by being inferred from one another. Let’s look at the specifics, starting with the propositional relation.

i. The Propositional Relation: Deductive Relations

We need to consider two relations from deductive logic: logical consistency and mutual derivability. At a minimum, coherence requires logical consistency. So a set of belief contents, p1, …. pn, is coherent only if p1, …. pn neither includes, nor logically entails, a contradiction. Logical consistency is far from sufficient, though, since a set of beliefs in a scattered array of propositions can be logically consistent without being justified. Consider, for example, my belief that Joan is sitting, my belief that 2+2=4, and my belief that tomorrow is Wednesday. While these beliefs are logically consistent with one another, more needs to be in place if they are to be justified.

This last set of beliefs illustrates another important point. While coherentists will claim that this set of beliefs does not exhibit coherence, it is at the same time implausible to claim that this set is incoherent. It is not incoherent, since no one of the beliefs is in direct conflict with, that is, contradicts, any of the others. It follows that coherence and incoherence are contraries, not contradictories. If a set of beliefs is coherent, then it is not incoherent; if a set of beliefs is incoherent, then it is not coherent; but as this last case illustrates, there are sets of beliefs that fail to be coherent, but are not incoherent either. The fact that coherence and incoherence are contraries explains the earlier point about why deeming incoherent beliefs unjustified is not enough to make one a coherentist. Just because a theory disqualifies incoherent beliefs from being justified, it is not thereby committed to holding that coherence is necessary for justification.

Consider, next, mutual derivability. Though it is plausible that logical consistency is necessary for coherence, it is too much to require that each believed proposition entail each of the other believed propositions in the system. In fact, it is even too much to require that each believed proposition entail at least one of the other believed propositions. To see why these requirements are too strong, consider these four beliefs: the belief that Moe is wincing, the belief that Moe is squealing, the belief that Moe is yelling “that hurts”, and the belief that Moe is in pain. None of these beliefs logically implies any of the others. Nor does the conjunction of any three of them imply the fourth. Despite the lack of entailments, though, the beliefs together seem to constitute a system of beliefs that is intuitively quite coherent. So coherence can be earned by relations weaker than entailment.

ii. The Propositional Relation: Inductive Relations

Many coherentists have required, in addition to logical consistency, probabilistic consistency. So if one believes that p is 0.9 likely to be true, then one would be required to believe that not-p is 0.1 likely to be true. Here probability assignments appear in the content of what is believed. Alternatively, a theory of probability might generate consistency constraints by imposing constraints on the degrees of confidence with which we believe things. So take a person who believes p, but is not fully confident that p is correct; she believes p to a degree of 0.9. Here 0.9 is not part of the content of what she believes; it measures her confidence in believing p. Consistency might then require that she believe not-p to a degree of 0.1. In one of these two ways, the axioms of probability might help set coherence constraints.

Besides being probabilistically consistent with one another, coherent beliefs gain in justification from being inferred from one another in conformity with the canons of cogent inductive reasoning. Foundationalists, at least moderate foundationalists, have just as much at stake in the project of identifying these canons. It is common to identify distinct branches of inductive reasoning, each with their own respective canons: for example, inference to the best explanation, enumerative induction, and various forms of statistical reasoning. For present purposes, what is crucial in all of this is that beliefs inferred from one another in conformity with the identified canons (whatever the exact canons are) boost coherence, and therefore justification.

iii. The Propositional Relation: Explanatory Relations

To supplement the requirements of logical, and probabilistic, consistency, coherentists often introduce explanatory relations. This allows them to concur that the system consisting in the beliefs that Moe is wincing, Moe is squealing, and Moe is yelling “that hurts” coheres with the belief that Moe is in pain. In addition, it allows us to disqualify the set consisting in my beliefs that Joan is sitting, 2+2=4, and tomorrow is Wednesday on the grounds that these propositions do not in any way explain one another.

There are two ways that a proposition can be involved in an explanatory relation: as being what is explained, or as being what does the explaining. These are not exclusive. The fact there are toxic fumes in the room is explained by the fact that the cap is off the bottle of toxic liquid. The fact that there are toxic fumes in the room, in turn, explains the fact that I am feeling sick. So I might believe that I am feeling sick, draw an explanatory inference and believe that there must be toxic fumes in the air, and then from that belief draw a second explanatory inference and believe that the cap must be off the bottle. In this case, that there are toxic fumes in the air serves to both explain why I am sick and in turn serves as the explanatory basis for the cap being off the bottle. Often what drives coherentists to think that a coherent set of beliefs must consist in more than two beliefs is that the needed explanatory richness requires more than two beliefs.

Disagreement enters when coherentists say exactly what makes one thing a good explanation of another. Among the determinants of good explanation are predictive power, simplicity, fit with other claims that one is justified in believing, and fecundity in answering questions. The nature and relative weight of these, and other, determinants is quite controversial. At this level of detail, coherentists, even so-called explanationists who stress the central played by explanatory considerations, frequently diverge.

Not all coherentists include explanatory relations among the determinants of coherence. See Lehrer (1990) for example. Those that do include them usually give one of two kinds of accounts for why believed propositions that do a good job of explaining one another increase coherence and hence boost justification. One kind of account claims that when beliefs do this, they make each other more likely to be true. On this kind of account, explanatory relations are construed as ultimately being inductive probabilifying relations. On an alterative account, explanatory relations are irreducible ingredients of coherence, ingredients that are simply obvious parts of what contributes to coherence.

iv. The Psychological Realization Condition

It is not enough that the contents of a person’s beliefs happen to cohere with one another. Another condition is needed. In the cognizer’s mind, these beliefs must stand in some relation to one another. This extra condition might be incorporated into an account of a belief system. Let’s consider another way of incorporating the condition. Suppose some coherentist elects to individuate belief systems by the subject-matter of the belief contents. Such a coherentist might then introduce a distinct psychological realization condition, one that figures into an account of the coherence relation rather than into an account of a system of beliefs. If the beliefs in some system are to cohere with one another, they must interact with one another – for example, by being inferred from one another.

On the inferential approach a belief coheres with the rest of the beliefs in some system of beliefs only if it stands in one of two inferential relations to beliefs in that system of beliefs: it might be inferred from one, or more, beliefs in the system; or, it might be a belief from which one, or more, beliefs in the system have been inferred.

But inference is just one option. Arguably, another option would be to impose a counterfactual condition. Roughly, this kind of condition says that a belief coheres with other beliefs in the system to which it belongs only if the following counterfactual conditional claim is true: if the rest of the system were markedly different, in some specified way, then the person would not hold that belief.

4. Arguments for Coherentism

Let’s now survey some of the main arguments for, and against, coherentism. This section reviews four arguments for coherentism. The first attempts to show that coherence is sufficient for justification. Three more attempt to show that it is necessary.

a. For Sufficiency: The Argument from Increased Probability

In An Analysis of Knowledge and Valuation, C.I. Lewis (1883-1964) introduced a case that has been widely discussed. A number of witnesses report the same thing about some event – for example, that Nancy was at last night’s party. However, the witnesses are unreliable about this sort of thing. Moreover, their reports are made completely independently of one another – in other words, the report of any one witness was in no way influenced by the report of any of the other witnesses. According to Lewis, the “congruence of the reports establishes a high probability of what they agree upon.” (p. 246) The point is meant to generalize: whenever a number of unreliable sources operate independently of one another, and they converge with the same finding, this boosts the probability that that finding is correct. This is so regardless of whether the sources are individual testifiers, various sensory modalities, or any combination of sources. Items that individually are quite unreliable and would not justify belief, when taken together under conditions of independent operation and convergence, produce justified beliefs.

This argument has been charged with several shortcomings. For one, it is not clear that the argument, even if sound, establishes coherentism. The argument appears to rest on an inference to the best explanation, one that can be construed along foundationalist lines. So, for each source, S1 . . . Sn, I am justified in believing S1 reports p, S2 reports p . . . Sn reports p. According to foundationalists, these beliefs are justified without being inferred from any other beliefs; they are basic beliefs. Then, inferring to the best explanation, I come to believe p. This belief-that-p is a non-basic belief, but since it rests on basic beliefs, the overall picture is a foundationalist one, not a coherentist one.

Second, even on standard coherence views, it is not clear that the reports-that-p cohere with one another. Logical coherence, both in the sense of logical consistency and in the sense of mutual derivability, is in place; but the explanatory relations that coherentists so often emphasize are not.

Third, it is controversial whether the argument is cogent. One issue here concerns whether each source, taken individually, provides justification for believing p. If each independently confers some justification, then one of coherentism’s rivals – namely, a version of foundationalism which says that coherence can boost overall justification, but cannot generate justification from scratch – can agree. On the other hand, if each source fails on its own to confer any justification whatsoever, then the question remains: does this kind of case show that coherence can create justification from scratch? If the argument is to establish that coherence is by itself sufficient to generate justification, we need to take each individual source as, on its own, providing no justification whatsoever for believing p. Recently Bayesian proofs have been offered to show that the convergence of such sources does not increase the probability of p (see Huemer 1997 and Olson 2005). Their convergence would have been just as likely had p been false.

b. For Necessity: Only Beliefs can Justify Other Beliefs

The next coherentist argument traces to work by Wilfrid Sellars (1973) and Donald Davidson (1986). Often this argument is put forth as an anti-foundationalist argument. However, if successful, it establishes the stronger positive claim of necessity coherentism. According to this argument, only beliefs are suited to justify beliefs. As Davidson puts it, “nothing can count as a reason for holding a belief except another belief” (1986, p.126). Consider the obvious alternative – what justifies our empirical beliefs about the external world are perceptual states. But perceptual states are either states that have propositions as their objects, or they don’t. If they have propositions as their objects, then we need to be aware of these propositions in the sense that we need to believe these propositions in order for the initial belief to be justified. But it is these further beliefs that are really doing the justifying. On the other hand, if they do not have propositions as objects, then, no logical relations can hold between their objects and the propositional contents of the beliefs that they are supposed to justify. That seems to leave perceptual states standing in only causal relations to the relevant empirical beliefs. But, Davidson claims, the mere fact that a belief is caused by a perceptual state implies nothing about whether that belief is justified.

Foundationalists have replied in a number of ways. First, suppose perceptual states do not take propositions as their objects. It is not clear why there needs to be a logical relation between the objects of perceptual states, and the contents of the beliefs that they are supposed to justify. Non-perceptual states can figure into statements of conditional probability, so that on their obtaining, a given belief is likely to be true to some degree or other. Alternatively, they can bear explanatory relations to the beliefs that they are alleged to justify. Second, suppose the relevant perceptual states do take propositions as their objects. It is not at all obvious that one needs to be aware of them for them to justify, though perhaps one does need to be aware of them if one is to show that one’s belief is justified. Here, the coherentist argument is often charged with conflating the notion of a justified belief with the notion of being in a position to show that one’s belief is justified.

c. For Necessity: The Need for Justified Background Beliefs

Coherentists sometimes argue in the following way. First, they invoke a prosaic justified belief about the external world – say my present belief that there is a computer in front of me. Then they claim that this belief is justified only if I am justified in believing that the lighting is normal, that my eyes are functioning properly, that no tricks are being played on me, and so forth. For if I am not justified in making these assumptions, then my belief that there is a computer in front of me would not be justified. Generalizing, the claim is that our beliefs about the external world are justified only if some set of justified background beliefs is in place.

This argument has also been challenged. The key claim–that my belief that there is a computer in front of me is justified only if I am justified in believing these other things–is not obvious. A young child, for example, might believe there is a computer in front of her, and this belief might be justified, even though she is not yet justified in believing anything about the lighting, her visual processes, and so forth. If this is correct, then the most the argument can show is that if someone has a justified belief that there is a computer in front of them and if they believe that the lighting is normal, that their eyes are functioning well, and so forth, then these latter beliefs had better be justified. This, however, is consistent with foundationalism. Moreover, some epistemologists argue that the psychological realization condition might not be met. For it is implausible to think that I infer that there is a computer in front of me from one or more of my beliefs about the lighting, my eyes, and absence of tricksters. Nor do I infer any of these latter beliefs from my belief that there is a computer in front of me. Maybe this non-content requirement will do instead: my computer belief is counterfactually dependent on my beliefs about the lighting, my eyes, and so forth, so that if I did not have any of the latter beliefs, then I would not have the computer belief either. This is far from obvious, though. Perhaps, in the imagined counterfactual situation, my state is like the child’s. So even a relation of counterfactual dependence might not be needed.

d. For Necessity: The Need for Meta-Beliefs

There is another argument that begins from a prosaic justified belief about the external world. Consider, again, my empirically justified belief that there is a computer in front of me. For this belief to be justified, I must possess some reason for holding it. But to possess a reason is to believe that reason. Since the reason presumably needs to be a good one, I must believe it in such a way that my belief in that reason is a justified belief. This yields a second justified belief. This second justified belief can then be subjected to the same argument, an argument that will yield some third justified belief. And so on.

Foundationalists have charged that this argument is psychologically unrealistic. Surely, having a justified belief that there is a computer in front of me does not require having an infinite number of justified beliefs. Coherentists have a good reason to avoid being committed to this kind of result: it is much more psychologically realistic to posit coherent systems of beliefs that are finite. If this is right, the argument is best thought of as a reductio ad absurdum of one, or more, of the claims that lead to the result – either the claim that justified belief requires possessing a reason, the claim that possessing a reason requires believing that reason, or the claim that possessing a reason requires believing it with justification.

Moreover, this argument does not clearly support coherentism. Instead, it seems to support infinitism. Plus, the demand that it makes is a demand for linear justification: my computer belief relies for its justification on my having a second justified belief; in turn, this second justified belief relies for its justification on my having some third justified belief. These dependency relations are asymmetric one-way relations, the hallmark of linear justification, not coherence justification.

5. Arguments Against Coherentism

This section takes up five arguments against coherentism. These are in addition to the circularity and self-support charges that that were discussed earlier.

a. Against Sufficiency: The Input and Isolation Arguments

One argument against sufficiency coherentism says that it fails to recognize the indispensable role that experience plays in justifying our beliefs about the external world. That sufficiency coherentism gives no essential role to experience follows from the fact that the states that suffice to justify our beliefs are, on this view, limited to other beliefs. That this is grounds for rejecting sufficiency coherentism is spelled out in several different ways. One way appeals to a lack of connection to the truth: since the view does not give any essential role to the central source of input from the external world, namely experience, there is no reason to expect a coherent system of beliefs to accurately reflect the external world. This line of attack is often referred to as the isolation objection. Alternatively, an opponent of sufficiency coherentism might not appeal to truth-conductivity. Instead, she might simply claim that it is implausible to deny that part of what justifies my present belief that there is a computer in front of me is the nature of my present visual and tactile experiences. So even if my experience is not reflective of the truth, perhaps because I am a deceived brain-in-a-vat, my perceptual beliefs will be justified only if they suitably fit with what my perceptual states are reporting.

Of course, proponents of necessity coherentism are free to impose other necessary conditions on justified belief, conditions that can include things about experience. But what about proponents of sufficiency coherentism? How can they respond? Let’s look at three ways. The first is from Laurence BonJour (1985, chapters 6 and 7). BonJour identifies a class of beliefs that he calls cognitively spontaneous beliefs. Roughly, these are non-inferential beliefs that arise in us in a non-voluntary way. A subset of these beliefs can be justified from within one’s system of beliefs by appeal to two other beliefs: the belief that these first-order beliefs occur spontaneously, plus the belief that first-order spontaneous beliefs of a specific kind (a kind individuated by its characteristic subject matter, or by its “apparent mode of sensory production”) tend to be true. According to BonJour, invoking cognitively spontaneous beliefs in this way explains how experience can make a difference to the justificatory status of our beliefs – experiences do this via their being reflected in a subset of our beliefs. BonJour contends that in addition a coherentist must give an account of how experiences must make a difference to the justification of some of our beliefs. Here, he introduces the Observation Requirement: roughly, any system of beliefs that contains empirically justified beliefs must include the belief that a significant likelihood of truth attaches to a reasonable variety of cognitively spontaneous beliefs.

Alternatively, Keith Lehrer (see chapter 6 of his 1990 book) calls on the fact that a human’s typical body of beliefs is going to include beliefs about the conditions under which she reliably forms beliefs. Lehrer points out that this belief is either true or false. If it is true, then in tandem with beliefs about the conditions under which one formed some beliefs, plus the beliefs themselves, the truth of the beliefs, and their being justified, follows. On the other hand, if a belief about the conditions under which one reliably forms beliefs is false, then the justification for the relevant belief is defeated (this entails that one fails to know, though the belief still enjoys what Lehrer calls “personal justification”).

Third, a coherentist might challenge the assumption that experiences and beliefs are distinct. On some views of perceptual states (for example, the view that Armstrong defends in chapter 10 of his 1968 book), perceptual states, or at least a significant class of perceptual states, involve, and entail, believing. On these views, when one of the relevant perceptual states supplies input from the external world, one’s corpus of beliefs is provided with input from the external world. The viability of this response turns on the case for thinking that perceiving is believing.

b. Against Sufficiency: The Alternative Coherent Systems Argument

A second argument against sufficiency coherentism connects in some ways with the last argument. According to this second argument, for each system of coherent beliefs, there are multiple alternative systems – alternative because they include beliefs with different, logically incompatible, contents – that are just as coherent. However, if there are plenty of highly, equally coherent, but incompatible, systems, and if few of these systems do an adequate job of faithfully representing reality, then coherentism is not a good indicator of truth. Since this line of reasoning is readily knowable, beliefs that coherently fit together are not, at least by virtue of their coherence alone, justified.

The exact number of alternative systems that are equally coherent depends on the exact details of what constitutes coherence. But like most of the standard arguments for, and against, coherentism, the soundness of this argument is not thought to turn on these details. Nor is it clear that coherentists can reply by denying the view of epistemic justification invoked in the argument. Even if one were to deny the externalist thesis which says that the mark of justified beliefs is that they are likely to be true, in some objective non-epistemic sense of “likely,” epistemic internalism might not provide refuge. For BonJour, Lehrer, and other internalists, beliefs that are not likely, in the same externalist sense, to be true can be justified: for example, my belief that there is a computer in front of me would be justified even if I were a lifelong deceived brain-in-a-vat. But it is not clear that it is reasonable, by internalist lights, to hold a coherent system of beliefs just because they are coherent, while it is reasonable to believe that there are plenty of alternative equally coherent, but incompatible, belief systems. So, this objection might go through whether one weds coherentism to epistemic externalism or internalism.

A sufficiency coherentist might try to respond to this argument in the same way that she responds to the input problem. She might claim, for example, that a sufficient bulk of a person’s beliefs are cognitively spontaneous beliefs. Since these beliefs are involuntarily acquired, they will constrain the number, and nature, of alternative equally coherent systems that one could have. Alternatively, a large bulk of our beliefs will be firmly in place if perceiving is believing.

c. Against Necessity: Feasibility Problems

Let’s turn to some arguments against necessity coherentism. It is highly plausible that humans have plenty of justified beliefs. So, if justification requires coherence, it must be psychologically realistic to think that each of us has coherent systems of beliefs. How psychologically realistic is this?

Again, the answer depends, in part, on the make up of the coherence relation. As we saw, coherence at a minimum requires logical consistency. Christopher Cherniak (see Cherniak 1984) considers using a truth-table to determine whether a system of 138 beliefs is logically consistent. If one were so quick that one could check each line of the truth table for this long conjunction in the time it takes a light ray to traverse the diameter of a proton, it would still take more than twenty billion years to work through the entire table. Since 138 beliefs is hardly an inordinate number of beliefs for a system to have, it appears that coherence cannot be checked for in any humanly feasible way.

While this sort of consideration might pose a problem for a position that couples coherentism with internalism (as BonJour and Lehrer do), coherentism itself does not require a person to verify that it is logically consistent. It does not even require that a person be able to verify this. It just requires that the system in fact be logically consistent. Still, there might be problems in the neighborhood. One is that Cherniak’s point might well imply that we do not form, or sustain, our beliefs in virtue of their coherence, since any cognitive mechanism that could do this would need to be much more powerful than any mechanisms we have. Second, it is highly plausible to think that we are often in a position to show that our beliefs are justified; but Cherniak’s point suggests that if coherentism were right, this would often be beyond our abilities.

d. Against Necessity: The Preface Paradox

Another argument questions whether logical inconsistency, an obvious mark of incoherence, really entails a lack of justification. Imagine an historian who has just completed her lifelong book project. She has double and triple checked each claim that she makes in the book, and each has checked out. For each of the claims she makes, c1, ….. cn, she has a justified belief that it is true: she has the justified belief that c1 is true, the justified belief that c2 is true, … , and the justified belief that cn is true. At the same time, she is fully aware of the fact that historians make mistakes. In all likelihood, her book contains at least one mistake. For this reason, she is justified in believing that at least one of the claims that she makes in her book is false. But this yields a set of beliefs that is not logically consistent, since it includes the belief that c1 is true, the belief that c2 is true, … , the belief that cn is true, and the belief that at least one of c1 through cn is false. Some epistemologists, for example, Foley 1992, have argued that the historian is justified in believing this set of logically inconsistent claims. And, all of these beliefs remain justified even if she knows they are logically inconsistent.

In response, the coherentist might appropriate any of a number of views on this Preface Paradox. For example, John Pollock (1986) has suggested a simple reason for thinking that the historian’s beliefs cannot be both logically inconsistent and justified. Since a set of inconsistent propositions logically implies anything whatsoever, adding a widely accepted principle concerning justification will yield the result that one can be justified in believing anything whatsoever. The principle is the closure principle: roughly, it says that if one is justified in believing some set of propositions and one is justified in believing that those propositions logically imply some other proposition, then upon deducing this other proposition from the set that one starts from, one is justified in believing that proposition.

A second set of cases involve beliefs that are logically inconsistent, although this is unknown to the person who holds them. For example, while Frege had good reason to believe that the axioms of arithmetic that he came up with were consistent, Russell showed that in fact they were not consistent. It is quite plausible that Frege’s beliefs in each of the axioms were, though logically inconsistent, nonetheless justified (see Kornblith 1989). BonJour (1989) responded to this case, as well as the Preface Paradox, by agreeing that both Frege’s, and the historian’s beliefs, are justified. He claimed that logical consistency is overrated; it is, in fact, not an essential component of coherence.

e. Against Necessity: Counterexamples

There appear to be straightforward counterexamples to coherentism. Introspective beliefs constitute an important class of such cases. On a broad interpretation of “empirical” that encompasses sources of belief in addition to the sensory modalities (one that contrasts with the a priori), introspective beliefs count as empirical. Consider, then, my introspective belief that I am in pain, or my introspective belief that something looks red to me. These beliefs are not inferred from any other beliefs – I did not arrive at either of them by inference from premises. They are not based on any other beliefs.

In response, Lehrer (1990, p. 89) has suggested that a coherentist might identify one, or more, background beliefs, and claim that, though the introspective belief is not inferred from these background belief, the introspective belief is justified because it coheres with the background beliefs. For example, to handle the introspective belief that something looks red to me, Lehrer points to the background belief that if I believe something looks red to me then, unless something untoward is going on, the best explanation is that there is something that does look red to me.

It is not clear that this response works. Let R be the proposition that something looks red to me. Lehrer’s suggestion requires that coherence holds between (i) R and (ii) if I believe R, then R. It is not clear, though, that coherence does hold between these. Though they are logically consistent, neither entails the other; moreover, they need not be inductively related to one another; nor is it clear that either explains the other.

6. Looking Ahead

Intense discussion of coherentism has been intermittent. Two recent defenses of the position, Laurence BonJour’s 1985 The Structure of Empirical Knowledge and Keith Lehrer’s 1990 version of Knowledge, significantly advanced the issues and triggered substantial literatures, which mostly attacked coherentism. But undoubtedly, work on coherentism has suffered from the fact that so few philosophers are coherentists. Even BonJour, who did so much to reinvigorate the discussion, has abandoned coherentism. See his 1999 paper for his renunciation. With the exception of work being done by Bayesians, few epistemologists are presently working on coherentism.

Epistemology would be better off if this were not so. For even if coherentism falls to some objection, it would be nice if we had a better idea of exactly what range of positions fall. Moreover, when it comes to the task of clarifying the nature of coherence, an appeal can be made to many foundationalists. While there might not be much motivation to develop a position that one rejects, there is this: many foundationalists want to incorporate considerations about coherence. As we saw, they usually do this in one of two ways, either by allowing coherence to boost the level of justification enjoyed by beliefs that are independently justified in some non-coherentist fashion, or by stamping incoherent beliefs as unjustified. Defending these conditions on justification requires clarifying the nature of coherence. So, it is not just coherentists that have a stake in clarifying coherence.

7. References and Further Reading

• Akiba, Ken. (2000) “Shogenji’s Probabilistic Measure of Coherence is Incoherent.” Analysis 60: 356-359.
• Aristotle. (1989) Posteriori Analytics. Trans. Robin Smith. Indianapolis, IN: Hackett Publishing Company.
• Armstrong, David. (1968) A Materialist Theory of the Mind. New York: Routledge.
• Audi, Robert. (1993) The Structure of Justification. New York: Cambridge University Press.
• Aune, Bruce. (1967) Knowledge, Mind, and Nature. New York: Random House.
• Blanshard, Brand. (1939) The Nature of Thought. New York: G. Allen and Unwin Ltd.
• BonJour, Laurence. (1985) The Structure of Empirical Knowledge. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
• BonJour, Laurence. (1989) “Replies and Clarificiations.” In John Bender, ed., The Current State of the Coherence Theory. Dordrecht: Kluwer.
• BonJour, Laurence. (1999) “The Dialectic of Foundationalism and Coherentism.” In John Greco and Ernest Sosa, eds., The Blackwell Guide to Epistemology. Malden, MA: Blackwell.
• Cherniak, Christopher. (1984) “Computational Complexity and the Universal Acceptance of Logic.” Journal of Philosophy 81: 739-758.
• Chisholm, Roderick. (1982) The Foundations of Knowing. Minneapolis, MN: University of Minnesota Press.
• Chisholm, Roderick (1989) Theory of Knowledge 3rd edition. Englewood Cliffs, CA: Prentice Hall.
• Cross, Charles. (1999) “Coherence and Truth Conducive Justification.” Analysis 59: 186-193.
• Daniels, Norman. (1996) Justice and Justification: Reflective Equilibrium in Theory and Practice. Cambridge, MA: Cambridge University Press.
• Davidson, Donald. (1986) “A Coherence Theory of Truth and Knowledge.” In Ernest LePore, ed., Truth and Interpretation: Perspectives on the Philosophy of Donald Davidson. New York: Blackwell.
• Earman, John. (1992) Bayes or Bust? Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
• Elgin, Catherine. (2005) “Non-foundationalist Epistemology: Holism, Coherence, and Tenability.” In Matthias Steup and Ernest Sosa, eds., Contemporary Debates in Epistemology. Malden, MA: Blackwell.
• Foley, Richard. (1978) “Inferential Justification and the Infinite Regress.” American Philosophical Quarterly 15: 311-316.
• Foley, Richard. (1987) The Theory of Epistemic Rationality. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
• Foley, Richard. (1992) “Being Knowingly Incoherent.” Nous 26: 181-203.
• Goldman, Alan. (1988) Empirical Knowledge. Berkeley, CA: University of California Press.
• Goodman, Nelson. (1951) The Structure of Appearance. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
• Haack, Susan. (1993) Evidence and Inquiry. Cambridge, MA: Blackwell.
• Hansson, S.O. and Erik Olsson (1999) “Providing Foundations for Coherentism.” Erkenntnis 51: 243-265.
• Harman, Gilbert. (1973) Thought. Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
• Harman, Gilbert. (1986) Change in View. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
• Horwich, Paul. (1982) Probability and Evidence. New York: Cambridge University Press.
• Huemer, Michael. (1997) “Probability and Coherence Justification.” Southern Journal of Philosophy 35: 463-472.
• Jeffrey, Richard. (1983) The Logic of Decision 2nd edition. Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
• Klein, Peter. (1985) “The Virtues of Inconsistency.” The Monist 68: 105-135.
• Klein, Peter. (1999) “Human Knowledge and the Infinite Regress of Reasons.” Philosophical Perspectives 13: 297-325.
• Klein, Peter and Ted Warfield. (1994) “What Price Coherence?” Analysis 54: 129-132.
• Klein, Peter and Ted Warfield. (1996) “No Help for the Coherentist.” Analysis 56: 118-121.
• Kornblith, Hilary. (1989). “The Unattainability of Coherence.” In John Bender, ed., The Current State of the Coherence Theory. Dordrecht: Kluwer.
• Kvanvig, Jonathan. (1995) “Coherentists’ Distractions.” Philosophical Topics 23: 257-75.
• Kvanvig, Jonathan. (2003) “Coherentist Theories of Epistemic Justification, Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
• Kvanvig, Jonathan. (2003) The Value of Knowledge and the Pursuit of Understanding. New York: Cambridge University Press.
• Kvanvig, Jonathan and Wayne Riggs. (1992) “Can a Coherence Theory Appeal to Appearance States?” Philosophical Studies 67: 197-217.
• Lehrer, Keith. (1974) Knowledge. New York: Oxford University Press.
• Lehrer, Keith. (1997) “Justification, Coherence, and Knowledge.” Erkenntnis 50: 243-257.
• Lehrer, Keith. (1990) Theory of Knowledge. Boulder, CO: Westview Press.
• Lewis, C.I. (1946) An Analysis of Knowledge and Valuation. LaSalle, IL: Open Court.
• Lycan, William. (1988) Judgment and Justification. New York: Cambridge University Press.
• Lycan, William. (1996) “Plantinga and Coherentisms.” In Jonathan Kvanvig, ed., Warrant in Contemporary Epistemology. Totowa, N.J.: Rowman and Littlefield.
• Makinson, David. (1965) “The Paradox of the Preface.” Analysis 25: 205-207.
• Merricks, Trenton. (1995) “On Behalf of the Coherentist.” Analysis 55: 306-309.
• Olsson, Erik. (1999) “Cohering With.” Erkenntnis 50: 273-291.
• Olsson, Erik. (2001) “Why Coherence is not Truth-Conducive.” Analysis 61: 236-241.
• Olsson, Erik. (2002) “What is the Problem of Coherence and Truth?” Journal of Philosophy 99: 246-272.
• Olsson, Erik. (2005) Against Coherence: Truth, Probability, and Justification. New York: Oxford University Press.
• Plantinga, Alvin. (1993) Warrant: The Current Debate. New York: Oxford University Press.
• Pollock, John. (1979) “A Plethora of Epistemological Theories.” In George Pappas ed., Justification and Knowledge. Dordrecht: Kluwer.
• Pollock, John. (1986) “The Paradox of the Preface.” Philosophy of Science 53: 246-258.
• Pollock, John. (1986) Contemporary Theories of Knowledge. Totowa, N.J.: Rowman and Littlefield.
• Post, John. (1980) “Infinite Regresses of Justification and Explanation.” Philosophical Studies 38: 31-52.
• Pryor, James. (2005) “There Is Immediate Justification.” In Matthias Steup and Ernest Sosa eds., Contemporary Debates in Epistemology. Malden, MA: Blackwell.
• Quine, W. and J. Ullian. (1970) The Web of Belief. New York: Random House.
• Ramsey, F.P. (1931) “Truth and Probability.” In R.B. Braithwaite, ed., The Foundations of Mathematics and Other Logical Essays. London: Routledge & Keegan Paul.
• Rawls, John. (1971) A Theory of Justice. Boston, MA: Harvard University Press.
• Rescher, Nicholas. (1973) The Coherence Theory of Truth. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Sellars, Wilfrid. (1963) Science, Perception and Reality. New York: Humanities Press.
• Sellars, Wilfrid. (1973) “Givenness and Explanatory Coherence.” Journal of Philosophy 70: 612-624.
• Shogenji, Tomoji. (1999) “Is Coherence Truth-Conducive?” Analysis 59: 338-345.
• Shogenji, Tomoji. (2001) “Reply to Akiba on the Probabilistic Measure of Coherence.” Analysis 61: 147-150.
• Shogenji, Tomoji. (2005) “Justification by Coherence from Scratch.” Philosophical Studies 125: 305-325.
• Sosa, Ernest. (1991) Knowledge in Perspective: Essays in Epistemology. New York: Cambridge University Press.
• Swain, Marshell. (1989) “BonJour’s Coherence Theory of Justification.” In John Bender, ed., The Current State of the Coherence Theory. Dordrecht: Kluwer.
• Thagard, Paul. (2000) Coherence in Thought and Action. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
• Van Cleve, James. (2005) “Why Coherence Is Not Enough: A Defense of Moderate Foundationalism.” In Mathias Steup and Ernest Sosa, eds., Contemporary Debates in Epistemology. Malden, MA: Blackwell.
• van Fraassen, Bas. (1989) Laws and Symmetry. New York: Oxford University Press.

Author Information

Peter Murphy
Email: pjmurphy469@yahoo.com
University of Indianapolis
U. S. A.

Contextualism in Epistemology

In very general terms, epistemological contextualism maintains that whether one knows is somehow relative to context. Certain features of contexts—features such as the intentions and presuppositions of the members of a conversational context—shape the standards that one must meet in order for one’s beliefs to count as knowledge. This allows for the possibility that different contexts set different epistemic standards, and contextualists invariably maintain that the standards do in fact vary from context to context. In some contexts, the epistemic standards are unusually high, and it is difficult, if not impossible, for our beliefs to count as knowledge in such contexts. In most contexts, however, the epistemic standards are comparatively low, and our beliefs can and often do count as knowledge in these contexts. The primary arguments for epistemological contextualism claim that contextualism best explains our epistemic judgments—it explains why we judge in most contexts that we have knowledge and why we judge in some contexts that we don’t—and that contextualism provides the best solution to puzzles generated by skeptical arguments.

Table of Contents

1. Introduction
2. Subjunctive Conditionals Contextualism
3. Relevant Alternatives Contextualism and Rejecting Closure
   1. Dretske’s Relevant Alternatives Theory of Knowledge
   2. Relevant Alternatives Contextualisms that Reject Closure
4. Relevant Alternatives Contextualism and Accepting Closure
5. Contextualism and Epistemic Rationality
6. Other Forms of Epistemological Contextualism
   1. Explanatory Contextualism
   2. Evidential Contextualism
   3. Contextualism as a Theory of Knowledge
7. Objections to Contextualism
8. Alternatives to Contextualism
9. Conclusion
10. References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

Epistemological contextualism has evolved primarily as a response to views that maintain that we have no knowledge of the world around us. Taking quite seriously the problems presented by skepticism, contextualists seek to resolve the apparent conflict between claims like the following:

1. I know that I have hands.
2. But I don’t know that I have hands if I don’t know that I’m not a brain-in-a-vat (that is, a bodiless brain that is floating in a vat of nutrients and that is electrochemically stimulated in a way that generates perceptual experiences that are exactly similar to those that I am now having in what I take to be normal circumstances).
3. I don’t know that I’m not a brain-in-a-vat (henceforth, a BIV).

These claims, when taken together, present a puzzle. (1), (2), and (3) are independently plausible yet mutually inconsistent. That (1) is plausible seems to require no explanation. (3) is plausible because it seems that in order to know that I’m not a BIV, I must rule out the possibility that I am a BIV. Yet the BIV and I have perceptual experiences that are exactly similar—it seems to the BIV, just as it seems to me, that he has hands, that he is sitting at his desk and in front of his computer, and so on. Accordingly, my perceptual experiences give me no reason to favor the belief that I am not a BIV over the belief that I am. Thus, since I have only my perceptual experiences to go on, I cannot rule out the possibility that I’m a BIV. Considerations like these contribute to (3)’s plausibility.

Moreover, it seems that I can’t know that I have hands—and, in general, that I can’t know that I have any body at all —if I can’t rule out the possibility that I’m a bodiless BIV. This, then, contributes to the plausibility of (2). It seems in addition that (2) always retains its plausibility, no matter how high or low we set the standards for knowledge. Keith DeRose (1999a) defends this claim by noting that it is always a comparative fact that my epistemic position with respect to the claim that I’m not a BIV is just as strong as my epistemic position with respect to the claim that I have hands. If this is correct, then (2) is true across contexts, no matter what the epistemic standards.

Yet in spite of the fact that they are independently plausible, (1), (2), and (3) are mutually inconsistent; they cannot all be true. It seems, therefore, that we must give up one of these claims. But which one should we give up, and why?

In trying to answer these questions, contextualists maintain that ‘know’ either is or functions very much like an indexical, that is, an expression whose semantic content (or meaning) depends on the context of its use. For example, the word ‘here’ is an indexical. I say, “Jaime is here,” and what I mean depends on where I am when I say it. If I’m in the conference room, then I mean, all other things being equal, that Jaime is in the conference room. ‘I’ is also an indexical—its meaning depends on the context of its use and, in particular, on who is using it. When Jaime says, “I am in the conference room,” then he means, all other things being equal, that Jaime is in the conference room. Yet when Julie uses ‘I’, she means something different; Julie’s ‘I’ means Julie.

If ‘know’ is an indexical, its semantic content (or meaning) will depend on the context in which it is used. Furthermore, since context will affect the semantic content of ‘know’, context will have an effect on the semantic content of complex lexical items in which ‘know’ appears, for example, on the semantic content of knowledge attributions like ‘Jaime knows that he’s in the conference room’. Contextualists have put the point this way:

the truth-conditions of knowledge ascribing and knowledge denying sentences (sentences of the form ‘S knows that P’ and ‘S doesn’t know that P’ and related variants of such sentences) vary in certain ways according to the contexts in which they are uttered. What so varies is the epistemic standards that S must meet (or, in the case of a denial of knowledge, fail to meet) in order for such a statement to be true. (DeRose 1999a, p. 187)

Given this, contextualists maintain that (1), (2), and (3) do not in fact conflict, even though it seems that they do. They suggest, first of all, that some contexts set very high epistemic standards, standards according to which knowledge requires a great deal. Contexts in which these high standards are in play are typically those in which we are considering and taking seriously certain skeptical hypotheses. For example, in order to know anything at all about the world around us, these high standards might require us to rule out the possibility that we are BIVs, or the possibility that we are now dreaming, or the possibility that we are now being deceived by an omnipotent but malevolent demon. Yet our perceptual experiences afford us no evidence that would allow us to rule out these skeptical possibilities, for if we were BIVs, for example, we would be having exactly the same perceptual experiences that we’re now having. Thus, we fail to meet these high epistemic standards with respect both to the belief that I have hands and to the belief that I’m not a BIV. (1) is therefore false in these high-standards contexts while (3) is true. According to contextualists, then, we should reject (1) in high-standards contexts. When we do so, we are no longer faced with a conflict, for the conflict presents itself only when we insist on the truth of each of the three mutually inconsistent claims. Moreover, in rejecting (1) in high-standards contexts, contextualism gives the skeptic his due, and takes seriously the compelling nature of skeptical arguments.

Nevertheless, contextualists maintain that in most contexts, the epistemic standards are comparatively low. Typically, these are ordinary contexts in which we are considering no skeptical hypotheses. In such contexts, we can have knowledge of the world around us without eliminating skeptical possibilities like the BIV possibility. In order to know that I have a hand, for example, I need eliminate only possibilities like those in which I have no hands, or in which I have paws or claws instead of hands. Moreover, the evidence provided by my perceptual experiences—the evidence that I obtain by looking at my hands, or by hearing the sounds made when I clap them together—does allow me to eliminate these possibilities. Thus, we can meet the epistemic standards that are in place in low-standards contexts. (1) is therefore true in these contexts while (3) is false. According to contextualists, then, we should reject (3) in low-standards contexts. And here again, in rejecting (3), we keep the conflict between (1), (2), and (3) from presenting itself. Moreover, in rejecting (3) in low-standards contexts, contextualism allows us to retain our ordinary knowledge—it allows us to know the things we ordinarily take ourselves to know.

Yet if we are never actually faced with a conflict between (1), (2), and (3), why does it seem as if we are? Contextualists respond in this way: Since we most often find ourselves in low-standards contexts, we tend to evaluate knowledge attributions according to the epistemic standards that are in place in those contexts. Thus, we tend to reckon (1) true. However, since (3) makes explicit reference to BIVs, our evaluation of that claim tends to lead us to entertain the BIV skeptical scenario. Doing this can raise the epistemic standards—it can push us into a context in which the epistemic standards are quite high—and so we tend to reckon (3) true. And so it seems that we are faced with a conflict between (1), (2), and (3). Yet it merely seems as if we are faced with such a conflict. For, as we have seen, when the epistemic standards are high, (1) is false while (3) is true. But when the standards are lower, (1) is true while (3) is false.

Contextualism also allows us to explain why it seems in certain contexts that we don’t know that we have hands (for example). We make these epistemic judgments at least partly because it’s true in such contexts that we don’t know that we have hands. And we judge in other contexts that we know that we have hands at least partly because such claims are true in those other contexts. Thus, contextualism not only helps us to see our way out of apparent conflicts like those between (1), (2), and (3), but it also helps us to explain why we make the epistemic judgments that we do.

The most prominent forms of epistemological contextualism are based either on Robert Nozick’s subjunctive conditionals account of knowledge or on the relevant alternatives theory of knowledge that is associated with Fred Dretske and Alvin Goldman. The primary difference between these two forms of contextualism is in how they characterize epistemic standards. As we will see, the former characterizes the standards in terms of subjunctive conditionals, while the latter characterizes them in terms of relevant alternatives. We will consider subjunctive conditionals contextualism in Section 2 and relevant alternatives contextualism in Sections 3 and 4. Some forms of contextualism, however, are based on neither of these theories. One such view is the version of contextualism that Stewart Cohen advocates most recently, and we will consider this view in Section 5. Let us turn now, though, to subjunctive conditionals contextualism.

2. Subjunctive Conditionals Contextualism

Keith DeRose provides an influential brand of epistemological contextualism. It is intended to solve the puzzles generated by groups of statements like the following:

1. I know that I have hands.
2. But I don’t know that I have hands if I don’t know that I’m not a BIV.
3. I don’t know that I’m not a BIV.

DeRose claims that in contexts in which the standards for knowledge are unusually high, we should reject (1) and that the skeptic can truthfully say in such contexts that I don’t know that I have hands. In other contexts, however, the epistemic standards are more relaxed and we can both reject (3) and correctly say that I do know that I have hands.

DeRose’s contextualist solution seeks to explain the plausibility of (3) by utilizing resources provided by Robert Nozick. Specifically, DeRose’s solution appeals to the Subjunctive Conditionals Account (SCA) of the plausibility of (3). According to SCA, “we have a very strong general, though not exceptionless, inclination to think that we don’t know that P when we think that our belief that P is a belief we would hold even if P were false” (DeRose 1999a, p. 193). DeRose calls the belief that P insensitive if it is one that we would hold even if P were false. SCA’s generalization thus becomes: We are inclined to think that S doesn’t know that P if we think that S’s belief that P is insensitive.

DeRose claims that even though this generalization does not represent our ordinary standard for knowledge, there are contexts in which the skeptic puts it into place as the standard (for example, by mentioning skeptical possibilities like the possibility that you are now a BIV). The standard in such contexts is the skeptical standard, according to which my beliefs must be sensitive if they are to count as knowledge. When this standard is in place, as it is in skeptical contexts, I fail to know that I’m not a BIV. For my belief that I’m not a BIV is not sensitive: I would believe that I wasn’t a BIV even if I were a BIV. Moreover, since (2) is true in all contexts, it follows that I don’t know in skeptical contexts that I have hands. In this way, DeRose’s contextualism explains the plausibility of (3) and gives the skeptic his due by arguing that there are contexts in which we should reject (1).

But DeRose wants to avoid the boldly skeptical conclusion that I never know that I have hands, and he does this by arguing that in ordinary contexts of knowledge attribution—contexts in which the skeptical standard is not in place and in which the epistemic standards are comparatively low—we can reject (3). In these contexts, the skeptical standard is not in place, and our beliefs need not be sensitive in order to count as knowledge. Thus, we can truthfully assert in ordinary contexts that I do know that I have hands. And, since (2) is true in all contexts, it follows that I know in ordinary contexts that I’m not a BIV. In this way, DeRose’s contextualism explains the plausibility of rejecting (3) and allows us to retain the knowledge that we ordinarily take ourselves to have.

According to DeRose, the relevant difference between these contexts is that the standards for knowledge are quite high in skeptical contexts but comparatively low in ordinary ones. But what accounts for this difference? DeRose recognizes that he must “explain how the standards for knowledge are raised [by the skeptic]” (DeRose 1999a, p. 206) if his solution is to be adequate. Essential to this explanation is DeRose’s Rule of Sensitivity:

When someone asserts that S knows (or does not know) that P, the standards for knowledge tend to be raised, if need be, to a level such that S’s belief that P must be sensitive if it is to count as knowledge. (DeRose 1999a, p. 206)

He then provides the following explanation of how the skeptic raises the standards.

In utilizing [puzzles like those generated by (1)-(3)] to attack our putative knowledge of O [where O is a proposition that we ordinarily take ourselves to know], the skeptic instinctively chooses her skeptical hypothesis, H, so that it will have these two features: (1) We will be in at least as strong a position to know that not-H as we’re in to know that O, but (2) Any belief we might have to the effect that not-H will be an insensitive belief…. Given feature (2), the skeptic’s assertion that we don’t know that not-H, by the Rule of Sensitivity, drives the standards for knowledge up to such a point as to make that assertion true. …And since we’re in no stronger an epistemic position with respect to O than we’re in with respect to not-H (feature (1)), then, at the high standards put in place by the skeptic’s assertion of [(3)], we also fail to know that O. (DeRose 1999a, pp. 206-7)

DeRose maintains, then, that the skeptic’s assertion is the mechanism she uses to raise the standards for knowledge. When the skeptic asserts that I don’t know that I’m not a BIV, the Rule of Sensitivity is invoked, and the standards for knowledge are raised to such a level that my beliefs must be sensitive if they are to count as knowledge. And since my belief that I’m not a BIV is not sensitive—that is, since I would believe that I wasn’t a BIV even if I were a BIV—I do not know in skeptical contexts that I’m not a BIV. Thus, given the truth of (2), I do not know in skeptical contexts that I have hands (or, for that matter, anything that I ordinarily take myself to know.)

Nevertheless, when no one mentions a skeptical hypothesis, the Rule of Sensitivity is not invoked, and the epistemic standards allow beliefs to count as knowledge even though they are not sensitive. This means that in ordinary contexts, we are still in a position to know the things we ordinarily take ourselves to know.

3. Relevant Alternatives Contextualism and Rejecting Closure

Perhaps the main motivation for epistemological contextualism is now the relevant alternatives theory of knowledge. There are two kinds of relevant alternatives contextualism. One kind rejects the closure principle, according to which knowledge is closed under known implication:

If S knows that p, and knows that p implies q, then S knows that q.

The closure principle is both plausible and explanatorily valuable. For one thing, it helps to explain how we come to know things via deduction. I know, for example, that tomorrow is Saturday. I know this because I know that today is Friday and that if today is Friday then tomorrow is Saturday. The closure principle helps to account for this knowledge, and the fact that I come to know things via deduction—and in accordance with the closure principle—renders that principle both plausible and desirable.

A second kind of relevant alternatives contextualism accepts the closure principle.

In Section 3.2, we will consider Mark Heller’s relevant alternatives contextualism, which represents accounts that reject the closure principle. Before examining Heller’s contextualism, however, we should consider the theory that motivates it.

a. Dretske’s Relevant Alternatives Theory of Knowledge

Fred Dretske proposes “to think of knowledge as an evidential state in which all relevant alternatives (to what is known) are eliminated” (Dretske 2000b, p. 52). This is the relevant alternatives theory of knowledge, or RA. But this leaves several questions unanswered.

First, what is an alternative to p? A proposition q is an alternative to p if and only if it cannot be true both that q and that p. Thus, the proposition that this animal is a Siberian grebe is an alternative to the proposition that it’s a Gadwall duck. For the animal cannot be both a Siberian grebe and a Gadwall duck.

Second, what is a relevant alternative to p? Dretske says that a relevant alternative is an alternative “that a person must be in a[n] evidential position to exclude (when he knows that P)” (Dretske 2000b, p. 57). But this doesn’t help very much at all. What is it about the alternatives that S must exclude that makes them such that she must exclude them? Unfortunately, there is no widely accepted response to this question. The vote seems to be split between two candidates. Some, including Dretske, say that an alternative q is relevant only if there is an objective possibility that q. But others say that q can be a relevant alternative simply because we regard q as a possibility.

Third, what does it mean to eliminate a relevant alternative? Here, too, there is disagreement. One view about elimination is the strongest view, according to which S can eliminate a relevant alternative q only if her evidence for believing not-q is strong enough to allow her to know that not-q. A proponent of RA might instead adopt the strong view, according to which S can eliminate q if her evidence for thinking that not-q is either strong enough to allow her to know that not-q or strong enough to allow her to have very good reason to believe that not-q. A proponent of RA might also adopt the weak view, according to which S can eliminate a relevant alternative q by meeting one of the following three conditions: (i) her evidence for not-q is strong enough to allow her to know that not-q, (ii) her evidence for not-q is strong enough to allow her to have very good reason to believe that not-q, or (iii) S’s belief that not-q is epistemically non-evidentially rational, where this is “a way in which it can be rational (or reasonable) [for S] to believe [that not-q] without possessing evidence for the belief” (Cohen 1988, p. 112). Some RA contextualists make it clear that they have something like the weak view in mind (see Cohen 1988 and Stine 1976), but most fail to make it clear which of the three views they adopt.

Dretske argues that I can know that p without eliminating the irrelevant alternatives to p. Still, he maintains that my knowing that p entails nothing whatsoever about whether I know that q, where q is an irrelevant alternative to p and might even be a necessary consequence of p. This amounts to a denial of the closure principle. Suppose that the alternative that this is a Siberian grebe is irrelevant to my knowing that it is a Gadwall duck. Notice too that the negation of the former proposition is a necessary consequence of the latter proposition—if this is a Gadwall duck, then it is not a Siberian grebe. Dretske claims that I can know that this is a Gadwall duck even though I don’t know that it’s not a Siberian grebe. Thus, Dretske holds that the closure principle is false.

This verdict is quite controversial, however, and there is disagreement over this matter even among proponents of RA. I see the lines of this disagreement as boundaries between different kinds of RA theories, and we can classify RA theories according to whether they accept or reject closure. We might choose to do this partly because RA contextualists, as well as RA theorists in general, tend to make it clear whether they accept closure, while they do not always make it clear where they stand on other issues (e.g., on the issue of relevance and on the issue of elimination). Primarily, though, we should distinguish between RA contextualists who accept closure and those who reject it because their views about closure crucially influence how they respond to skepticism. As we shall shortly see, those who reject closure deny one of the conflicting claims, namely, (2), the claim that I don’t know that I have hands if I don’t know that I’m not a BIV. So, according to RA contextualists who reject closure, there really is no conflict at all between claims (1) and (3). But according to those who accept closure, there is such a conflict. For, by the closure principle, in contexts in which I don’t know that certain skeptical alternatives do not obtain, I also fail to know certain things about the external world.

In Section 4, we will see how RA contextualists who accept closure respond to skepticism. In the following section, however, we will examine the response provided by RA contextualists who reject closure.

b. Relevant Alternatives Contextualisms that Reject Closure

Consider the puzzle that is generated by the following argument:

1. I don’t know that I’m not a BIV in a treeless world (that is, a BIVT).
2. If I know that there is a tree before me (call the italicized proposition T), and I know that T implies my not being a BIVT, then I know that I’m not a BIVT.
3. So, I don’t know that T (given that I know that T implies my not being a BIVT).

In “Relevant Alternatives and Closure,” Mark Heller follows Dretske’s lead and argues that we can solve this skeptical puzzle by rejecting the closure principle, of which (5) is an instance.

To show why we should give up (5) (and hence the closure principle), Heller argues for a particular interpretation of RA. He claims that (5) is false if his interpretation of RA is true. He calls his interpretation Expanded Relevant Alternatives, or ERA.

(ERA) S knows that p only if S does not believe p in any of the closest not-p worlds or any more distant not-p worlds that are still close enough.

ERA accounts for our inclination to think, for example, that if I know that T, I will not believe that T in any of the closest worlds in which it’s not the case that T. In addition, ERA accounts for our inclination to think that something else is sometimes needed if I am to know that T. Imagine that “the actual world is cluttered with papier mâché tree facsimiles which S is unable to distinguish from real trees” (Heller 1999b, p. 200). In this case, we are inclined to say that S doesn’t know that T even if she doesn’t believe that T in any of the closest not-T worlds. Here, even though worlds that are cluttered with papier mâché tree facsimiles are not among the closest not-T worlds, they are close enough to the actual world to count as relevant. So Heller claims that in at least some cases, if S is to know that p, she must not believe that p in any of the close enough not-p worlds.

ERA provides the foundation for a relevant alternatives contextualism, for it allows us to see different contexts as setting different epistemic standards. Which not-p worlds count as epistemically relevant—that is, which not-p worlds count as being close enough to the actual world—will vary from context to context. And since ERA characterizes epistemic standards in terms of relevant alternatives (that is, in terms of relevant not-p worlds), it allows for the context-sensitivity of epistemic standards.

In light of this, Heller maintains, we may solve the skeptical puzzle by concluding that (5) is false. Note first of all that there are no contexts in which I know that I’m not a BIVT. Given ERA, if I am to know that I’m not a BIVT, I must not believe that I’m not a BIVT in any of the closest BIVT worlds. Thus, since I do believe that I’m not a BIVT in the closest BIVT worlds, I don’t know that I’m not a BIVT.

Nevertheless, there are contexts in which I do know that T. This is true because we use “different worlds as relevant alternatives when considering whether [I know that T] from those used when considering whether [I know that I’m not a BIVT]” (Heller 1999b, p. 197). According to ERA, I know in C that T because I don’t believe that T in any of the not-T worlds that are close enough to the actual world. (And we need consider only the close enough not-T worlds because those worlds include the closest not-T worlds.) So given that ERA is true, (5) is false: I can know that there is a tree before me (and hence evade the skeptic’s snare) even though I don’t know that I’m not a BIVT. We can therefore solve the skeptical puzzle by giving up the closure principle.

Any solution to the skeptical puzzle that denies the truth of (5) must explain why it seems to us that (5) is true. In providing this explanation, Heller argues that (5) seems true because some contexts conform to the demands of the closure principle. For example, there are contexts in which astonishingly distant not-T worlds—for example, worlds in which I am a BIVT—are close enough to the actual world to count as epistemically relevant. In those contexts, I know neither that T nor that I’m not a BIVT. For, in BIVT worlds, I believe both that T and that I’m not a BIVT. The fact that there are contexts such as these, contexts that conform to the demands of the closure principle, can make it seem that (5) is true.

4. Relevant Alternatives Contextualism and Accepting Closure

Some relevant alternatives contextualisms accept the closure principle. In this section, we will examine the contextualist theory espoused by Stewart Cohen in his influential article “How to be a Fallibilist.” Cohen’s theory is perhaps the most prominent relevant alternatives contextualism and should be counted among the most notable of all contextualisms.

Cohen’s contextualism, like others, is intended to solve certain skeptical puzzles. The puzzle with which Cohen is concerned is familiar—it consists of three independently plausible but mutually inconsistent propositions.

1. I know that I have hands.
2. If I don’t know that I’m not a BIV, then I don’t know that I have hands.
3. I don’t know that I’m not a BIV.

To solve this paradox, Cohen relies on a relevant alternatives contextualism, one that accepts the plausibility—and indeed the truth—of proposition (2), which follows from the closure principle (given that I know that my having hands implies my not being a BIV). Cohen claims that in skeptical contexts, contexts in which the BIV alternative is relevant, we should accept propositions (2) and (3) but deny proposition (1). However, in ordinary contexts, contexts in which the BIV alternative is not relevant, we should accept (1) and (2) but deny (3).

Let’s look at the details of Cohen’s account. For Cohen,

an alternative (to [some proposition] q) h is relevant (for [some person] S) = df S’s epistemic position with respect to h precludes S from knowing q. (Cohen 1988, p. 101)

Cohen also claims that there are criteria of relevance and that these criteria ought to reflect our intuitions about the conditions under which S knows that q. He says that our intuitions are influenced both by conditions that are internal and by conditions that are external to a person’s evidence. Accordingly, he offers two criteria of relevance. First, there is the external criterion.

An alternative (to p) h is relevant if the probability of h conditional on reason r and certain features of the circumstances is sufficiently high (where the level of probability that is sufficient is determined by context). (Cohen 1988, p. 102)

By this criterion, the fact that there are a number of cleverly painted mules in the zoo, whether or not I have any evidence for this fact, can be sufficient to make relevant the alternative that this is a cleverly painted mule. Presumably, if there are a number of cleverly painted mules in the zoo, it is probable to some determinate degree d that this is a cleverly painted mule rather than, say, a zebra. And according to Cohen, the context determines, for example, that probabilities of degree d* and higher are sufficiently high to render an alternative relevant. Thus, according to the external criterion, if d is greater than or equal to d*, the alternative that this is a cleverly painted mule will be relevant in this context.

Second, there is the internal criterion.

An alternative (to q) h is relevant if S lacks sufficient evidence (reason) to deny h, i.e., to believe not-h (Cohen 1988, p. 103),

where the amount of evidence that is sufficient is presumably determined by context. By this criterion, the amount of evidence that S has for her belief that this is not a cleverly painted mule can be sufficiently low to make relevant the alternative that it is a cleverly painted mule. We may again presume that S has a determinate amount of evidence a for her belief that this is not a cleverly painted mule. Here, the context determines, say, that amounts of evidence a* and lower are sufficiently low to render an alternative relevant. So if a is less than or equal to a*, the alternative that this is a cleverly painted mule will be relevant in this context.

Both the internal criterion and the external criterion are sensitive to context. According to Cohen, then,

there will be no general specification of what constitutes sufficient evidence to deny an alternative in order for it not to be relevant, and as such, no general specification of what constitutes sufficient evidence to know q. Rather, this will depend on the context in which the attribution of knowledge occurs. (Cohen 1988, p. 103)

But how do the standards of relevance shift? Cohen recognizes that he must explain how this shift occurs if his contextualist solution to the skeptical paradox is to work. Because Cohen thinks of reasons as statistical in nature, he thinks that they advertise both the chance that we believe correctly on their basis and the chance that we believe erroneously on their basis. When the chances for error are highlighted, those chances become salient, and the standards for relevance shift. Thus, highlighting the chances for error allows certain alternatives to become relevant.

For example, suppose that I have reasons to believe that this is a zebra. It looks for all the world like a zebra; it is in an area of the zoo that is clearly marked “zebras”; I believe with good reason that zookeepers put only zebras in areas marked “zebras”; and so on. But perhaps someone underscores the fact that all of these reasons are compatible with this animal’s being a cleverly painted mule. Such mules look for all the world like zebras, and in a pinch even the most conscientious zookeeper might put such creatures in an area marked “zebras.” Underscoring these facts makes salient the chance that I believe erroneously on the basis of my reasons, and it makes relevant the alternative that this is a cleverly painted mule.

This suggests that, for Cohen, the standards of relevance shift whenever someone underscores the statistical nature of our reasons, whenever someone points out that there is a chance that we believe erroneously on the basis of those reasons. So, in ordinary contexts, contexts in which no one underscores the chance that I believe erroneously, that chance will not be salient, and I can know on the basis of my reasons that this is a zebra. However, in skeptical contexts, contexts in which someone does underscore the chance that I believe erroneously, that chance will be salient. In these contexts, my attention will have been focused on the chance that I am wrong, and the alternative that this is a cleverly painted mule will be relevant. Since I cannot eliminate that alternative, I do not know that this is a zebra.

Cohen suggests that his relevant alternatives contextualism allows us to solve skeptical puzzles like those that focus on zebras and cleverly painted mules. This is because his version of the relevant alternatives theory is formulated in terms of evidence, and such puzzles involve beliefs for which we can have evidence. But Cohen suggests that radical skeptical paradoxes involve beliefs for which we can have no evidence—”radical skeptical hypotheses are immune to rejection on the basis of any evidence” (Cohen 1988, p. 111). As it is, then, Cohen’s relevant alternatives contextualism seems ill equipped to resolve radical skeptical paradoxes.

To overcome this difficulty, Cohen adjusts his version of the relevant alternatives theory so that it takes into account beliefs for which I can have no evidence. He claims that for some such beliefs it is epistemically rational for me to hold them even though I possess no evidence for them. He calls beliefs of this sort intrinsically rational beliefs. Among the intrinsically rational beliefs is my belief that I’m not a BIV. According to Cohen, it is rational for me to believe that I’m not a BIV even though I have no evidence for that belief.

Taking into account intrinsically rational beliefs, Cohen amends the internal criterion of relevance. First, he says that

it is reasonable for a subject S to believe a proposition q just in case S possesses sufficient evidence in support of q, or q is intrinsically rational. (Cohen 1988, p. 113)

He then provides the following amended version of the internal criterion, or ICa:

(ICa:) An alternative (to p) h is relevant if it is not sufficiently reasonable for S to deny h (to believe not-h), where, presumably, the degree of reasonableness that is sufficient is determined by context.

Cohen now notes that according to ICa: the alternative that I am a BIV is not ordinarily relevant. For my belief that I’m not a BIV is intrinsically rational. This means that the alternative that I am a BIV does not preclude me from knowing, on the basis of my reasons, that I have hands. Thus, I can know in ordinary contexts that I have hands (given both that my reasons are sufficient for my knowing that I have hands and that all relevant alternatives are eliminated). Furthermore, Cohen claims that since the standards are comparatively low in ordinary contexts, I can also know in those contexts that I’m not a BIV.

However, there are contexts in which the skeptic underscores the fact that I can have no evidence for my belief that I’m not a BIV. By doing this, the skeptic focuses my attention on the chance of error. According to Cohen, this makes relevant the alternative that I am a BIV, and I cannot eliminate that alternative. So, by the standards that apply in these skeptical contexts, I know neither that I’m not a BIV nor that I have hands. In this way, then, Cohen solves the radical skeptical puzzle while maintaining that closure holds.

5. Contextualism and Epistemic Rationality

Certain objections have led Cohen to abandon the relevant alternatives contextualism that he presents in “How to be a Fallibilist” and to revise his contextualist solution to radical skeptical paradoxes. He is most troubled by two objections. First, he is troubled by the idea that I can have evidence for my belief that I’m not a BIV. Second, he is troubled by the idea that his account commits him to the view that I can have a priori knowledge of some contingent facts, in particular, of the fact that I’m not a BIV. On the view that he presents in “How to be a Fallibilist,” I can know that I’m not a BIV solely on the basis of the intrinsic rationality of denying that I am a BIV. According to Cohen (see Cohen 1999, p. 69), this means that I can know a priori that I’m not a BIV and hence that I can have a priori knowledge of some contingent facts. These two objections have led Cohen away from his earlier relevant alternatives contextualism.

Even though Cohen now admits that I can have evidence for my belief that I’m not a BIV, he still thinks that there are beliefs for which I can never have evidence. He formulates a new radical skeptical paradox in terms of such beliefs. Cohen asks us to imagine a creature that is a BIV but will never have evidence that it is. Call such a creature a BIV*. Now, my belief that I’m not a BIV* is a belief for which I will never have evidence. We can formulate the following new paradox in terms of that belief.

1. I know that I have hands.

1. f I don’t know that I’m not a BIV*, then I don’t know that I have hands.
2. I don’t know that I’m not a BIV*.

Since this paradox involves a skeptical hypothesis for which I can never have evidence, the idea that I can have evidence for my belief that I’m not a BIV* should not trouble Cohen’s solution to this new paradox.

But given that Cohen has abandoned the relevant alternatives framework, just what is his solution to the BIV* paradox? He notes first of all that my belief that I’m not a BIV* can be intrinsically rational, or what he now calls non-evidentially rational. Once again, S’s belief that p is non-evidentially rational if it is epistemically rational for S to believe that p even though S has no evidence for that belief. Furthermore, Cohen now suggests that

S knows that p if and only if her belief that p is epistemically rational to some degree d, where epistemic rationality has both an evidential and a non-evidential component, and where d is determined by context. (see Cohen 1999, pp. 63-69, 76-77)

Suppose, then, that I have a certain amount of evidence for my belief that I have hands, and that my belief that I have hands is therefore evidentially rational to degree de:. Suppose too that my belief that I’m not a BIV* is non-evidentially rational to some degree dne. Cohen claims that “the non-evidential rationality [of my belief that I’m not a BIV*] is a component of the overall rationality or justification for any empirical proposition” (Cohen 1999, p. 86, fn. 36). So we may suppose that my belief that I have hands is epistemically rational to degree d*, where d* equals de plus dne.

Cohen now says that the degree to which a belief must be epistemically rational if it is to count as knowledge is “determined by some complicated function of speaker intentions, listener expectations, presuppositions of the conversation, salience relations, etc.” (Cohen 1999, p. 61). He suggests that the listeners’ cooperation is an essential part of this function. He also claims that in ordinary contexts this complicated function specifies that a belief is sufficiently epistemically rational if it is epistemically rational to degree do. And d*—the degree to which my belief that I have hands is epistemically rational—is greater than do. This means that I can know in ordinary contexts that I have hands. “And since my having a hand entails my not being a brain-in-a-vat [and a fortiori a BIV*], in those same [ordinary] contexts, my belief that I am not a brain-in-a-vat is sufficiently rational for me to know I am not a brain-in-a-vat” (Cohen 1999, p. 77). This allows him to overcome the objection that I know a priori that I’m not a BIV, for “my knowledge that I am not a brain-in-a-vat is based, in part, on my empirical evidence (the evidence that I have a hand), and so is not a priori” (Cohen 1999, p. 76). In ordinary contexts, then, we accept propositions (1) and (7) of the new radical skeptical paradox, but deny proposition (8).

But in skeptical contexts the complicated function specifies that a belief is sufficiently epistemically rational only if it is epistemically rational to degree ds. And d* is less than Ds This means that in skeptical contexts “my belief that I have a hand is not sufficiently rational for me to know I have a hand. In those same [skeptical] contexts, I have no basis for knowing I am not a brain-in-a-vat” (Cohen 1999, p. 77). In skeptical contexts, we accept propositions (7) and (8) but deny proposition (1). In this way, then, Cohen solves the BIV* paradox while maintaining that closure holds.

6. Other Forms of Epistemological Contextualism

Besides those already discussed, a few other forms of epistemological contextualism warrant mention. We begin with the form that belongs to Steven Rieber, which is most similar to those already considered.

a. Explanatory Contextualism

In “Skepticism and Contrastive Explanation,” Steven Rieber provides a contextualist solution to the skeptical puzzle generated when (1), (2), and (3) are considered together. He first proposes the following analysis of knowledge:

S knows that P … iff: the fact that P explains why S believes that P. (Rieber 1998, p. 194)

He next claims that his analysis of knowledge “generates the sort of context-sensitivity needed to solve the skeptical puzzle” (Rieber 1998, p. 195). He says that “what counts as an explanation is highly context-dependent. In particular, as recent work on contrastive explanation has made clear, it can depend on an implied contrast” (Rieber 1998, p. 195). For example, only those who have syphilis contract paresis, but most of those who have syphilis never get paresis. Suppose that Smith has both syphilis and paresis. We might ask

(S) Does the fact that Smith has syphilis explain why he contracted paresis?

According to Rieber, the answer to this question can depend on what is being implicitly contrasted with Smith. If there is an implied contrast with Jones, who has neither syphilis nor paresis, then we understand (S) to be asking

(J) Does the fact that Smith has syphilis explain why he rather than Jones contracted paresis?

And the answer to (J) might well be yes. However, if there is an implied contrast with Brown, who has syphilis but did not contract paresis, then we understand (S) to be asking

(B) Does the fact that Smith has syphilis explain why he rather than Brown contracted paresis?

And the answer to (B) might well be no. So it seems that whether one thing explains another can depend on context. Thus, given Rieber’s explanatory analysis of knowledge, knowledge too will be context-sensitive.

Rieber’s analysis of knowledge seems to him to be well suited to solve the skeptical puzzle. He suggests that on his analysis of knowledge, to ask

(9) Do I know that I have hands?

is to ask

(9a) Does the fact that I have hands explain why I believe that I have hands?

Rieber claims that in ordinary contexts the answer to (9a) is clearly yes, and so I know in such contexts that I have hands. Presumably, I also know in those contexts that I’m not a BIV.

But a consideration of the BIV skeptical possibility can make salient a contrast with that possibility. When this contrast is salient, we understand (9) to be asking

(9b) Does the fact that I have hands rather than being a handless BIV explain why I believe that I have hands rather than that I am a handless BIV?

The answer to (9b) is no, for all of the evidence that I have for my belief that I have hands is compatible with my being a handless BIV. And whenever the answer to (9b) is no, so is the answer to (9). Thus, in skeptical contexts, contexts in which a contrast with the BIV possibility is salient, we should accept (3) but deny (1). The skeptic can truthfully say in such contexts that I know neither that I’m not a BIV nor that I have hands.

Rieber’s explanatory contextualism thus solves our skeptical puzzle. In ordinary contexts, we accept (1) and (2) but deny (3). I know in such contexts both that I have hands and that I’m not a BIV. However, when we consider certain skeptical possibilities, certain contrasts become salient. In these contexts, I know neither that I have hands nor that I’m not a BIV.

b. Evidential Contextualism

In “Contextualism and the Problem of the External World,” Ram Neta argues that the standards for knowledge are invariant, and therefore that we should not see the skeptic as being able to raise those standards. We ought instead to understand the skeptic to be restricting what can count as evidence. The skeptic does this, according to Neta, by exploiting the context-sensitivity of our attributions of evidence. When she brings up the BIV skeptical hypothesis, for example, the skeptic restricts what I can truthfully regard as my evidence to just those mental states that are available to me whether or not I am a BIV. That is, she prevents any of my current mental states from counting as evidence for my beliefs about the external world, thereby creating an unbridgeable (in this context, at least) epistemic gap between my evidence and my beliefs. In these contexts, my beliefs fail to meet the epistemic standard and therefore fail to count as knowledge. Still, in contexts in which I am considering no skeptical hypotheses, I can have plenty of evidence for my beliefs about the external world. In such contexts, my beliefs can meet the epistemic standards and can therefore count as knowledge. In this way, Neta’s version of contextualism, like the other versions we’ve considered, is meant to resolve familiar conflicts and to explain why we judge in most contexts that we have knowledge but why we judge in other contexts that we don’t.

c. Contextualism as a Theory of Knowledge

The last two forms of epistemological contextualism, those belonging to Michael Williams and to David Annis, have few similarities with the forms we’ve considered so far.

In his recent work, Williams argues for contextualism, which is, for him, the view that “independently of all [situational, disciplinary and other contextually variable factors], a proposition has no epistemic status whatsoever. There is no fact of the matter as to what kind of justification it either admits of or requires” (Williams 1996a, p. 119). His arguments for contextualism also count as arguments against epistemological realism, which is the view that even independently of contextual factors, there is a fact of the matter as to what kind of justification a belief requires. In particular, epistemological realism maintains the truth of the doctrine of epistemic priority (or DEP). According to DEP, our beliefs about the external world must be justified by sensory experience if they are to amount to knowledge. Williams argues that epistemological realism in general and DEP in particular are “contentious and possibly dispensable theoretical ideas about knowledge and justification” (Williams 1999b, p. 144). He also argues that skepticism depends essentially on these contentious ideas, and that, being theoretical, they are not forced on us by our ordinary ways of epistemic thinking. This suggests that skepticism is unnatural and thus that the burden of proof belongs to the skeptic. Yet since the skeptic cannot carry this burden, we have, according to Williams, no reason to take skepticism seriously.

Annis’ contextualism is meant to be an alternative both to foundationalism and to coherentism. Annis complains that both foundationalism and coherentism ignore the social nature of justification. According to his version of contextualism, then, S is justified in believing that p only if she can meet certain objections that express real doubts. These objections can include, but are not necessarily limited to, those according to which S is not in a position to know that p and those according to which p is false. We might object, for example, that since S is not reliable in situations like this, she is not in a position to know that the book on yonder shelf is brown. Thus, if S is to be justified in believing that the book is brown, she must be able to meet that objection. The justification of S’s belief that p also depends, according to Annis, on who offers certain objections and on the importance of S’s being right about p. It matters, for example, that it is S’s flight instructors, rather than her teasing friends, who object that she is unreliable when it comes to distinguishing the colors of fairly distant objects. A theory of justification that includes contextual parameters like these, Annis argues, fares better than either foundationalism or coherentism, both of which overlook the social nature of justification.

7. Objections to Contextualism

In this section, we will discuss two leading objections to epistemological contextualism. These are by no means the only criticisms that have been leveled against contextualism, but they introduce themes that have motivated additional objections as well as alternatives to contextualism. A discussion of these objections, then, should provide a center of operations for an exploration of objections to contextualism.

Palle Yourgrau (1983) argues that contextualism allows for dialogues such as the following since it claims that the standards for knowledge shift from context to context:

A: Is that a zebra?
B: Yes, it is a zebra.
A: But can you rule out its merely being a cleverly painted mule?
B: No, I can’t.
A: So you admit you didn’t know it was a zebra.
B: No, I did know then that it was a zebra. But after your question, I no longer knew.

This dialogue strikes Yourgrau as absurd, for it seems that nothing changes during the course of the conversation that would account for a change in B’s epistemic state: B is in just as good an epistemic position at the beginning of the conversation as she is at the end of the conversation, and so it seems that if B knows at the beginning, she should also know at the end. This suggests that, contrary to epistemological contextualism, we cannot affect shifts in the standards for knowledge simply by mentioning certain skeptical possibilities.

Contextualists (see DeRose 1992) have replied to this sort of objection by saying that once A introduces a skeptical possibility and thereby raises the standards for knowledge, B can no longer truly say, “I did know then that it was a zebra.” Once the standards for knowledge have been raised, the truth of any attribution of knowledge, including an attribution that is meant to apply only at some time in the past, must be judged according to those higher standards. Once the standards have been raised, B cannot both attribute knowledge to himself in the past and deny knowledge to himself in the present. He should now only deny himself knowledge; once the standards have been raised, neither B’s past self nor his present self knows that this is a zebra.

Stephen Schiffer has leveled a different sort of criticism at epistemological contextualism. Again, contextualism maintains that we attribute knowledge relative to standards that shift from context to context. This is to say, in effect, that when we say that B knows that this is a zebra, we mean that she knows relative to such-and-such an epistemic standard that this is a zebra. Putting this another way, contextualism maintains that our knowledge attributions are implicitly relative. Yet the contextualist’s response to Yourgrau’s objection suggests that B—or anyone else, for that matter—might fail to realize that our knowledge attributions are implicitly relative to an epistemic standard that shifts from context to context. Schiffer argues, however, that it is a general linguistic truth that speakers do realize that certain attributions are implicitly relative. For example, anyone who utters, “It’s raining,” in order to say that it’s raining in London knows full well that she’s asserting that it’s raining in London. Yet, according to Schiffer, when we utter, “B knows that it’s a zebra,” we typically do not take ourselves to be asserting that B knows relative to any standard. All this suggests, Schiffer argues, that the contextualist is wrong to think that our knowledge attributions are implicitly relative, and hence wrong to think that the standards for knowledge can shift from context to context.

8. Alternatives to Contextualism

Objections like these push people away from epistemological contextualism and toward theories that envisage epistemic standards that remain invariant from context to context. Two such theories present themselves as alternatives to contextualism. The first is skepticism, and the second is Mooreanism. Both skeptics and Mooreans maintain that the standards for knowledge do not shift. Yet while the skeptic claims that they are invariantly quite high, the Moorean claims that the standards are invariantly comparatively low.

The skeptic contends not only that there are no contexts in which we know that we’re not BIVs, but also that there are no contexts in which we know that we have hands (see, for example, Unger 1975 and Stone 2000). This response strikes some as implausible, however, since it does not accord with the thought that there are many contexts in which we can and do know things about the world around us.

The Moorean contends that there are never any insurmountable obstacles to our knowing both that we have hands and that we’re not BIVs.

Ernest Sosa’s Moorean response begins with the rejection of Nozick’s idea that knowledge requires sensitivity (see Section 2). He argues instead that knowledge requires safety, according to which S would believe that p only if it were the case that p (see Sosa 1999, p. 142). Moreover, both my belief that I have hands and my belief that I’m not a BIV are safe. Hence, both beliefs can always count as knowledge. Sosa says that

after all, not easily would one believe that [one was not radically deceived] without it being true … . In the actual world, and for quite a distance away from the actual world, up to quite remote possible worlds, our belief that we are not radically deceived matches the fact as to whether we are or are not radically deceived. (Sosa 1999, p. 147)

Yet if I can know across contexts that I’m not a BIV, why is it that it sometimes seems as if I don’t know that I’m not a BIV? Sosa maintains that since we can easily mistake safety for sensitivity, and since the belief that we’re not BIVs is not sensitive, it can sometimes seem to us that our belief that we’re not BIVs is not safe and thus that we don’t know that we’re not BIVs. Nevertheless, this is, according to Sosa, a mere appearance. For, since our belief is safe, we can know across contexts that we’re not BIVs and thus adopt a Moorean response to our skeptical puzzles.

Tim Black also provides a Moorean response to these puzzles. Employing Nozick’s sensitivity requirement for knowledge, Black argues in “A Moorean Response to Brain-in-a-Vat Scepticism” that the only worlds that are relevant to whether or not S knows that p are those in which S’s belief is produced by the method that actually produces it. This means that BIV worlds—possible worlds in which S is a BIV—are not relevant to whether S knows that she’s not a BIV. For BIV worlds are worlds in which her belief is produced by a method other than the one that actually produces it. Thus, since BIV worlds are not relevant to whether S know things about the external world, S can know both that she has hands and that she’s not a BIV. This, too, suggests a Moorean response to our skeptical puzzles.

9. Conclusion

We have now characterized epistemological contextualism in a way that allows several different theories to count as versions of that position. We have seen in particular that epistemological contextualists maintain that certain features of conversational contexts shape the standards that one must meet in order for one’s beliefs to count as knowledge. Understood in this way, a fairly wide range of views will count as versions of epistemological contextualism. Different versions will disagree over which features of conversational contexts can shape the epistemic standards, and over how the relevant contextual features help to shape those standards. Yet in spite of the differences between versions of epistemological contextualism, each seeks to achieve the valuable ends of explaining our epistemic judgments and solving the puzzles that are generated by skeptical arguments.

10. References and Further Reading

• Annis, David. (1978) “A Contextual Theory of Epistemic Justification.” American Philosophical Quarterly 15: 213-219.
• Austin, J. L. (1979) “Other Minds.” In Philosophical Papers, 3rd ed. New York: Oxford University Press.
• Black, Tim. (2002a) “A Moorean Response to Brain-in-a-Vat Scepticism.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 80: 148-163.
• Black, Tim. (2002b) “Relevant Alternatives and the Shifting Standards for Knowledge.” Southwest Philosophy Review 18: 23-32.
• Brueckner, Anthony. (1994) “The Shifting Content of Knowledge Attributions.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 54: 123-126.
• Cohen, Stewart. (1986) “Knowledge and Context.” Journal of Philosophy 83: 574-583.
• Cohen, Stewart. (1987) “Knowledge, Context, and Social Standards.” Synthese 73: 3-26.
• Cohen, Stewart. (1988) “How to be a Fallibilist.” Philosophical Perspectives 2, Epistemology: 91-123.
• Cohen, Stewart. (1998a) “Contextualist Solutions to Epistemological Problems: Scepticism, Gettier, and the Lottery.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 76: 289-306.
• Cohen, Stewart. (1998b) “Two Kinds of Skeptical Argument.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 58: 143-159.
• Cohen, Stewart. (1999) “Contextualism, Skepticism, and the Structure of Reasons.” Philosophical Perspectives 13, Epistemology: 57-89.
• Cohen, Stewart. (2000a) “Contextualism and Skepticism.” Philosophical Issues 10, Skepticism: 94-107.
• Cohen, Stewart. (2000b) “Replies [to Klein, Hawthorne, and Prades].” Philosophical Issues 10, Skepticism: 132-139.
• Cohen, Stewart. (2001) “Contextualism Defended: Comments on Richard Feldman’s ‘Skeptical Problems, Contextualist Solutions’.” Philosophical Studies 103: 87-98.
• DeRose, Keith. (1992) “Contextualism and Knowledge Attributions.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 52: 913-929.
• DeRose, Keith. (1996a) “Knowledge, Assertion and Lotteries.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 74: 568-580.
• DeRose, Keith. (1996b) “Relevant Alternatives and the Content of Knowledge Attributions.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 56: 193-197.
• DeRose, Keith. (1999a) “Solving the Skeptical Problem.” Reprinted in Keith DeRose and Ted A. Warfield, eds., Skepticism: A Contemporary Reader. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• DeRose, Keith. (1999b) “Contextualism: An Explanation and Defense.” In John Greco and Ernest Sosa, eds., The Blackwell Guide to Epistemology. Oxford: Blackwell.
• DeRose, Keith. (1999c) “Introduction: Responding to Skepticism.” In Keith DeRose and Ted A. Warfield, eds., Skepticism: A Contemporary Reader. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• DeRose, Keith. (2000a) “How Can We Know that We’re Not Brains In Vats?” Southern Journal of Philosophy 38 (Spindel Conference Supplement): 121-148.
• DeRose, Keith. (2000b) “Now You Know It, Now You Don’t.” Proceedings of the Twentieth World Congress of Philosophy: Volume V, Epistemology: 91-106.
• DeRose, Keith. (2002) “Assertion, Knowledge, and Context.” Philosophical Review 111 (2): 167-203.
• DeRose, Keith. (2004)a “Single Scoreboard Semantics.” Philosophical Studies 119 (1-2): 1-21.
• DeRose, Keith. (2004b) “Sosa, Safety, Sensitivity, and Skeptical Hypotheses.” In John Greco, ed., Sosa and His Critics. Oxford: Blackwell.
• Dretske, Fred I. (1981) Knowledge and the Flow of Information. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
• Dretske, Fred I. (2000a) “Epistemic Operators.” In Perception, Knowledge and Belief: Selected Essays. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Dretske, Fred I. (2000b) “The Pragmatic Dimension of Knowledge.” In Perception, Knowledge and Belief: Selected Essays. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Feldman, Richard. (1999) “Contextualism and Skepticism.” Philosophical Perspectives 13, Epistemology: 91-114.
• Feldman, Richard. (2001) “Skeptical Problems, Contextualist Solutions.” Philosophical Studies 103: 61-85.
• Fogelin, Robert J. (1999) “The Sceptic’s Burden.” International Journal of Philosophical Studies 7: 159-172.
• Garfinkel, Alan. (1981) Forms of Explanation. New Haven: Yale University Press.
• Goldman, Alvin I. (1976) “Discrimination and Perceptual Knowledge.” Journal of Philosophy 73: 771-791.
• Hambourger, Robert. (1987) “Justified Assertion and the Relativity of Knowledge.” Philosophical Studies 51: 241-269.
• Hawthorne, John. (2002) “Lewis, the Lottery and the Preface.” Analysis 62: 242-251.
• Heller, Mark. (1989) “Relevant Alternatives.” Philosophical Studies 55: 23-40.
• Heller, Mark. (1999a) “The Proper Role for Contextualism in an Anti-Luck Epistemology.” Philosophical Perspectives 13, Epistemology: 115-129.
• Heller, Mark. (1999b) “Relevant Alternatives and Closure.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 77: 196-208.
• Hofweber, Thomas. (1999) “Contextualism and the Meaning-Intention Problem.” In Kepa Korta, Ernest Sosa, Xabier Arrazola, eds., Cognition, Agency and Rationality. Dordrecht: Kluwer.
• Jacobson, Stephen. (2001) “Contextualism and Global Doubts about the World.” Synthese 129: 381-404.
• Johnsen, Bredo C. (2001) “Contextualist Swords, Skeptical Plowshares.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 62: 385-406.
• Klein, Peter. (2000) “Contextualism and the Real Nature of Academic Skepticism.” Philosophical Issues 10, Skepticism: 108-116.
• Kornblith, Hilary. (2000) “The Contextualist Evasion of Epistemology.” Philosophical Issues 10, Skepticism: 24-32.
• Lewis, David. (1979) “Scorekeeping in a Language Game.” Journal of Philosophical Logic 8: 339-359.
• Lewis, David. (1986) “Causal Explanation.” In Philosophical Papers, Volume II. New York: Oxford University Press.
• Lewis, David. (1996) “Elusive Knowledge.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 74: 549-567.
• Lipton, Peter. (1990) “Contrastive Explanation.” In Dudley Knowles, ed., Explanation and its Limits. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Lipton, Peter. (1991) Inference to the Best Explanation. London: Routledge.
• Neta, Ram. (2002) “S knows that p.” Noûs 36: 663-681.
• Neta, Ram. (2003) “Contextualism and the Problem of the External World.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 66: 1-31.
• Neta, Ram. (2003) “Skepticism, Contextualism, and Semantic Self-Knowledge.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 67 (2): 396–411.
• Nozick, Robert. (1981) Philosophical Explanations. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
• Oakley, I.T. (2001) “A Skeptic’s Reply to Lewisian Contextualism.” Canadian Journal of Philosophy 31: 309-332.
• Pritchard, Duncan. (2000) “Closure and Context.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 78: 275-280.
• Pritchard, Duncan. (2001) “Contextualism, Scepticism, and the Problem of Epistemic Descent.” Dialectica 55: 327-349.
• Pritchard, Duncan. (2002) “Recent Work on Radical Skepticism.” American Philosophical Quarterly 39: 215-257.
• Rieber, Steven. (1998) “Skepticism and Contrastive Explanation.” Noûs 32: 189-204.
• Rysiew, Patrick. (2001) “The Context-Sensitivity of Knowledge Attributions.” Noûs 35: 477-514.
• Schaffer, Jonathan. (2001) “Knowledge, Relevant Alternatives and Missed Clues.” Analysis 61: 202-208.
• Schaffer, Jonathan. (2004a) “From Contextualism to Contrastivism.” Philosophical Studies, 119 (1-2): 73-104.
• Schaffer, Jonathan. (2004b) “Skepticism, Contextualism, and Discrimination.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 69 (1): 138–155.
• Schiffer, Stephen. (1996) “Contextualist Solutions to Scepticism.” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society 96: 317-333.
• Shatz, David. (1981) “Reliability and Relevant Alternatives.” Philosophical Studies 39: 393-408.
• Shuger, Scott. (1983) “Knowledge and its Consequences.” American Philosophical Quarterly 20: 217-225.
• Sosa, Ernest. (1999) “How to Defeat Opposition to Moore.” Philosophical Perspectives 13, Epistemology: 141-153.
• Sosa, Ernest. (2000a) “Skepticism and Contextualism.” Philosophical Issues 10, Skepticism: 1-18.
• Sosa, Ernest. (2000b) “Replies [to Tomberlin, Kornblith, and Lehrer].” Philosophical Issues 10, Skepticism: 38-41.
• Sosa, Ernest. (2004) “Relevant Alternatives, Contextualism Included.” Philosophical Studies, 119 (1-2): 35-65.
• Stanley, Jason. (2000) “Context and Logical Form.” Linguistics and Philosophy 23: 391-434.
• Stanley, Jason. (2004) “On the Linguistic Basis for Contextualism.” Philosophical Studies, 119 (1-2): 119-146.
• Stine, Gail. (1976) “Skepticism, Relevant Alternatives, and Deductive Closure.” Philosophical Studies 29: 249-261.
• Stone, Jim. (2000) “Skepticism as a Theory of Knowledge.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 60: 527-545.
• Stroud, Barry. (1984) The Significance of Philosophical Scepticism. New York: Oxford University Press.
• Unger, Peter. (1975) Ignorance: A Case for Scepticism. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Unger, Peter. (1984) Philosophical Relativity. Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press.
• Unger, Peter. (1986) “The Cone Model of Knowledge.” Philosophical Topics 14: 125-178.
• Vogel, Jonathan. (1987) “Tracking, Closure, and Inductive Knowledge.” In Steven Luper-Foy, ed., The Possibility of Knowledge: Nozick and His Critics. Totowa, NJ: Rowman and Littlefield.
• Vogel, Jonathan. (1990) “Are There Counterexamples to the Closure Principle?” In Glenn Ross and Michael D. Roth, eds., Doubting: Contemporary Perspectives on Skepticism. Dordrecht: Reidel Publishing Company.
• Vogel, Jonathan. (1997) “Skepticism and Foundationalism: A Reply to Michael Williams.” Journal of Philosophical Research 22: 11-28.
• Vogel, Jonathan. (1999) “The New Relevant Alternatives Theory.” Philosophical Perspectives 13, Epistemology: 155-180.
• Williams, Michael. (1988) “Epistemological Realism and the Basis of Scepticism.” Mind 97: 415-439.
• Williams, Michael. (1996a) Unnatural Doubts: Epistemological Realism and the Basis of Scepticism. Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
• Williams, Michael. (1996b) “Understanding Human Knowledge Philosophically.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 56: 359-378.
• Williams, Michael. (1997) “Still Unnatural: A Reply to Vogel and Rorty.” Journal of Philosophical Research 22: 29-39.
• Williams, Michael. (1999a) Groundless Belief: An Essay on the Possibility of Epistemology, 2nd ed. Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
• Williams, Michael. (1999b) “Fogelin’s Neo-Pyrrhonism.” International Journal of Philosophical Studies 7: 141-158.
• Williams, Michael. (2001) “Contextualism, Externalism and Epistemic Standards.” Philosophical Studies 103: 1-23.
• Williamson, Timothy. (2001). “Comments on Michael Williams’ ‘Contextualism, Externalism and Epistemic Standards’.” Philosophical Studies 103: 25-33.
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Author Information

Tim Black
Email: tim.black@csun.edu
California State University, Northridge
U. S. A.

Epistemic Closure Principles

Epistemic closure principles state that the members of an epistemic set (such as propositions known by me) bear a given relation (such as known deductive entailment) only to other members of that epistemic set.  The principle of the closure of knowledge under known logical entailment is that one knows everything that one knows to be logically entailed by something else one knows.  For instance, if I know grass is green, and I know that grass is green deductively entails that grass is green or the sky is blue, then I know that grass is green or the sky is blue.  Epistemic closure principles are employed in philosophy in myriad ways, but some theorists reject such principles, and they remain controversial.

Some people see closure principles as capturing the idea that we can add to our store of knowledge by accepting propositions entailed by what we know; others claim that this is a misunderstanding, and that closure principles are silent as to how a piece of knowledge is, or can be, acquired.  For instance, the proposition I have a driver’s license issued by the state of North Carolina entails that North Carolina is not a mere figment of my imagination.  According to the principle that knowledge is closed under known entailment, if I know the former claim, and I know the entailment, I know the latter claim.  Some insist, however, that this must be distinguished from the (possibly) false claim that I could come to know the latter on the basis of my knowing the former, since my basis for knowing the former involves presupposing the latter (by taking my sense experience and memory at more or less face value, for instance).

Closure principles are employed in both skeptical and anti-skeptical arguments.  The skeptic points out that if one knows an ordinary common sense proposition (such as that one has hands) to be true, and knows that this proposition entails the falsity of a skeptical hypothesis (such as that one is a handless brain in a vat, all of whose experiences are hallucinatory), one could know the falsity of the skeptical hypothesis, in virtue of knowledge being closed under known entailment.  Since one cannot know the falsity of the skeptical hypothesis (or so the skeptic maintains), one also must not know the truth of the common sense claim that one has hands.  Alternatively, the anti-skeptic might insist that we do know the truth of the common sense proposition, and hence, in virtue of the closure principle, we can know that the skeptical hypothesis is false.  Although the closure principle is sometimes used by anti-skeptics, some view the rejection of closure as the key to refuting the skeptic.

Table of Contents

1. The Closure of Knowledge under Known Entailment
   1. The Closure of Knowledge Under Entailment
   2. The Closure of Knowledge Under Known Entailment
   3. Justification, Single-Premise and Multiple-Premise Closure
2. Philosophical Uses of the Closure Principle
3. Externalist Accounts of Knowledge and the Rejection of Closure
   1. Epistemic Externalism and Internalism
   2. Nozick’s Tracking Account of Knowledge and the Failure of Closure
   3. Dretske’s Externalist Account of Knowledge and Closure Failure
   4. “Abominable Conjunctions”
   5. Alternative Anti-Skeptical Strategies Need Not Reject Closure
   6. Some Skeptical Arguments do not Employ Closure
4. Dogmatism and the Rejection of Closure
5. The McKinsey Paradox, Closure, and Transmission Failure
   1. The McKinsey Paradox
   2. Davies, Wright, and the Closure/Transmission Distinction
6. Ordinary Propositions, Lottery Propositions, and Closure
7. References and Further Reading
   1. References
   2. Further Reading

1. The Closure of Knowledge under Known Entailment

a. The Closure of Knowledge Under Entailment

A set is closed under a particular relation if all the members of the set bear the relation only to other members of the set. The set of true propositions is closed under entailment because true propositions entail only other truths. Since false propositions sometimes entail truths, false propositions are not closed under entailment. Epistemic closure principles state that members of an epistemic set (such as my justified beliefs) are closed under a given relation (which may be a non-epistemic relation, like entailment, or an epistemic one, such as known entailment).

A simple closure principle is the principle that knowledge is closed under entailment:

If a subject S knows that p, and p entails q, then S knows that q.

Less schematically, this says that if one knows one thing to be true and the known claim logically entails a second thing, then one knows the second thing to be true. This principle has obvious counter-examples. A complicated theorem of logic is entailed by anything (and hence by any proposition one knows), but one may not realize this and may thus fail to believe (or even grasp) the theorem. Since one must at least believe a proposition in order to know that it is true, we see that one may fail to know something entailed by something else that one knows. Additionally, even if a proposition is entailed by something one knows, if one comes to believe the proposition through some epistemically unjustified process, one will fail to know the proposition (since one’s belief of it will be unjustified). For instance, if one knows that one will start a new job today and then comes to believe that one will either start a new job today or meet a handsome stranger based on the testimony of her astrologist, then perhaps she will fail to know the truth of the entailed disjunction.

b. The Closure of Knowledge Under Known Entailment

It is more plausible that knowledge is closed under known entailment:

If S knows that p, and knows that p entails q, then S knows that q.

As stated, however, the principle seems vulnerable to counter-examples similar to the ones just discussed. The subject might fail to put his knowledge that p together with knowledge that p entails q and thus fail to infer q at all. One might know that she has ten fingers and that if she has ten fingers then the number of her fingers is not prime, but simply not bother to go on to deduce and form the belief that her number of fingers is not prime. Alternatively, although the subject could have come to believe q by inferring it correctly from something else that she knows (since she is aware of the entailment), she instead might have come to believe q through some other, epistemically unjustified, process.

How can we capture the idea that one can add to one’s store of knowledge by recognizing and assenting to what is entailed by what one already knows? This formulation seems suitably qualified:

If S knows that p, and comes to believe that q by correctly deducing it from her belief that p, then S knows that q.

Less formally, if I know one thing, correctly deduce another thing from it, and come to believe this second thing by so deducing it, then I know the second thing to be true. This principle eliminates counterexamples in which the subject fails to believe the entailed claim (and thus fails to know it) or comes to believe the entailed claim for bad reasons (and thus fails to know the claim). (Henceforth, uses in this article of the phrase “the principle of closure of knowledge under known entailment” should be regarded as referring to this preferred formulation of the principle).

So much is built into the antecedent of this principle that it might now seem trivial but, as we shall see, it has been disputed on various grounds.

c. Justification, Single-Premise and Multiple-Premise Closure

We would seem to have similar grounds for supposing that justified belief is closed under known entailment. One is epistemically justified in believing whatever one correctly deduces from one’s justified beliefs. This captures the idea that one way to add to one’s store of justified beliefs is to believe things entailed by your justified beliefs. When one reasons validly, the justification that one has for the premises carries over to the conclusion.

The mere fact that justification is (ordinarily taken to be) one of the necessary conditions for knowledge does not strictly entail that justification is closed under the same operations (such as known entailment) that knowledge is closed under. As Steven Hales (1995) has pointed out, to argue in this manner is to commit the fallacy of division: to infer from the fact that a whole thing has a particular quality, that each of its components must have this quality as well. For instance, it does not follow from the fact that the glee club is loud that each, or even any, of the individual singers in the glee club is loud. Knowledge might be closed under known entailment even if justified belief is not, if all the counterexamples to the closure of justification were examples in which the justified belief was missing at least one of the necessary conditions for knowledge. There seems to be no particular reason to believe that this is the case, however. (See Brueckner 2004 for more on this point).

The closure principles discussed thus far are instances of single premise closure. For instance, one’s knowledge that a given particular premise is true, when combined with a correct deduction from that premise of a conclusion, seems to guarantee that one knows the conclusion. There are also multiple premise closure principles. Here is an example:

If S knows that p and knows that q, and S comes to believe r by correctly deducing it from p and q, then S knows that r.

That is, if I know two things to be true and can deduce a third thing from the first two, then I know the third thing to be true. There is good reason to be dubious of multiple premise closure principles of justification, such as

If S is justified in believing that p and justified in believing that q, and S correctly deduces r from p and q, then S is justified in believing that r.

Lottery examples reveal the difficulty. Given that there are a million lottery tickets and that exactly one of them must win, it is plausible (though not obvious) that for any particular lottery ticket, I am justified in believing that it will lose. So I am justified in believing that ticket one will lose, that ticket two will lose, and so forth, for every ticket. But if I know that there are a million tickets, and I am justified in believing each of a million claims to the effect that ticket n will lose and I can correctly deduce from these claims that no ticket will win, then by closure I would be justified in concluding that no ticket will win, which by hypothesis is false. Justified belief is fallible, in that one can be justified in believing something even if there is a chance that one is mistaken; conjoin enough of the right sort of justified but fallible beliefs and the resulting conjunction will be unlikely to be true, and thus unjustified.

If knowledge, like justified belief, is fallible (say, only 99.9% certainty is required), then multiple premise closure principles for knowledge will fail as well. One could be sufficiently certain for knowledge about each of a thousand claims (“I will not die today”; “I will not die tomorrow”; …; “I will not die exactly 569 days from today”; etc.), but not sufficiently certain of the conjunction of these claims (“I will not die on any of the next thousand days”) in order to know it, even though it is jointly entailed by those thousand known claims (and thus true). The fallibility of knowledge is far more controversial than the fallibility of justified belief, however.

Similarly, closure might be thought to hold for different types of knowledge, such as a priori knowledge (i.e. knowledge not gotten through sense experience, to oversimplify a bit). If one knows a priori that p, and knows a priori that p entails q, then one knows a priori that q. Intuitively, it seems that if one knows the premises of an argument a priori and is able to validly deduce a conclusion from those premises, one would know the conclusion a priori as well. This last point is on weaker ground, however, as discussed in Section 5b.

2. Philosophical Uses of the Closure Principle

The closure principle, now qualified to handle the straightforward counterexamples, has been employed in skeptical and anti-skeptical arguments, in support of a dogmatic refusal pay attention to evidence that counts against what one knows, to generate a paradox about self-knowledge, and for many other philosophical ends.  These uses are described in brief in this section, and in greater detail in later sections.

The skeptic may argue as follows:

1. I do not know that I am not a handless, artificially stimulated brain in a vat.
2. I do know that I have hands entails I am not a handless, artificially stimulated, brain in a vat.
3. If I know one thing, and I know that it entails a second thing, then I also know the second thing. (Closure)
4. Thus, I do not know that I have hands. (From 2 and 3, if I knew I had hands I would know that I am not a brain in a vat, in contradiction with 1).

If one really knew the ordinary common sense claim to be true, one could deduce the falsity of the skeptical claim from it and come to know that the skeptical claim is false (by closure). The fact that one cannot know that the skeptical claim is false (as per the first premise) demonstrates that one does not in fact know that the common sense proposition is true either. (See also Contemporary Skepticism).

But one person’s modus tollens (the inference from if p then q and not-q to the conclusion not-p) is another person’s modus ponens (the inference from if p then q and p to the conclusion q), as we can see from an anti-skeptical argument of the sort associated with G.E. Moore. (See Moore 1959).

1. I know that I have hands.
2. I know that I have hands entails I am not a handless, artificially stimulated, brain in a vat.
3. If I know one thing, and I know that it entails a second thing, then I also know the second thing. (Closure)
4. Thus, I know that I am not a handless, artificially stimulated brain in a vat.

From the fact that one knows that she has hands and this is incompatible with a skeptical hypothesis under which her hands are illusory, one can infer, and thus come to know (if closure is correct), the falsity of the skeptical hypothesis.

The closure principle can be used even in defense of a dogmatic rejection of any recalcitrant evidence that counts against something that one takes oneself to know. The argument runs as follows (adapted from Harman 1973):

1. I know my car is parked in Lot A. (Assume)
2. I know that if my car is parked in Lot A, and there is evidence that my car is not parked in Lot A (say, testimony that the car has been towed), then the evidence is misleading. (Analytic, since evidence against a truth must be misleading)
3. Thus, I know that any evidence that my car is not parked in Lot A is misleading. (Closure)
4. I know that there is evidence that my car is not parked in Lot A. (Assume)
5. Thus, I know that this evidence (testimony that my car was towed) is misleading. (Closure)
6. If a piece of evidence is known by me to be misleading, then I ought to disregard it. (Analytic)
7. Thus, I ought to disregard any evidence that my car is not parked in Lot A. (From 5 and 6)

This result seems paradoxical, however, as most would claim that it is epistemically irresponsible to ignore all the evidence against what one takes oneself to know, simply because it is evidence against what one takes oneself to know. It is plausible (though hardly obvious) that one takes oneself to know each thing that one believes (considered individually). If this is conjoined with the argument above, it entails that one ought to ignore any evidence against what one believes. This seems to be an even more ill-considered policy.

The closure principle also figures prominently in a paradox about self-knowledge and knowledge of the external world. It is now widely accepted that some thought contents are individuated externally. That is, there are some thought contents that one could not have unless one was in an environment or linguistic community that is a certain way. On this view, one could not think the thought that water is wet were one not in an environment with water, or at least with some causal connection to water. Given content externalism, it seems we may argue as follows (the argument is due to McKinsey 1991):

1. I know that I have mental property M (say, the thought that water is wet). (Assume privileged access to one’s own thoughts)
2. I know that if I have mental property M (the thought that water is wet), then I meet external conditions E (say, living in an environment containing water). (Externalism with respect to content)
3. If I know one thing, and I know that it entails a second thing, then I know the second thing. (The principle of the closure of knowledge under known entailment).
4. Thus, I know that I meet external conditions E (namely, that I live in environs containing water). (From 1, 2 and 3)

The conclusion follows from an application of the closure principle, but what makes this paradoxical is that it appears that the knowledge that is attributed in the premises depends on reflection alone (introspection plus a priori reasoning), whereas the knowledge attributed in the conclusion is empirical. If the premises are correct, and closure holds, I can know an empirical fact by reflection alone (since I know it on the basis of premises than can be known by reflection alone). Something seems to have gone wrong and it is unclear which premise, if any, is the culprit.

Closure principles figure in another philosophical puzzle about knowledge of “ordinary propositions”, those we ordinarily take ourselves to know, and “lottery propositions,” those that, although extremely likely, we do not ordinarily take ourselves to know. Suppose that one is struggling to get by on a pensioner’s income. It seems plausible to say that one knows one will not be able to afford a mansion on the French Riviera this year. However, that one will not be able to afford the mansion this year entails that one will not win the lottery. By the closure principle, since one knows that one will not be able to afford the mansion, and knows that this entails that one will not win the lottery, one must know that one will not win the lottery. However, very few are inclined at accept that one knows one will not win the lottery. After all, there’s a chance one could win.

3. Externalist Accounts of Knowledge and the Rejection of Closure

a. Epistemic Externalism and Internalism

To determine whether someone is epistemically justified in believing something, one must do so from a particular point of view. One may consider the point of the view of the agent who holds the belief or of someone who possesses all the relevant information (which may be unavailable to the agent). To oversimplify, those who consider only the subject’s perspective when evaluating the subject’s epistemic justification are epistemic internalists, and those who adopt the point of view of one with all the relevant information are epistemic externalists. An account of epistemic justification is internalist if it requires that all the elements necessary for an agent’s belief to be epistemically justified are cognitively accessible to the agent; that is, these elements (say, evidence or reasons) must be internal to the agent’s perspective. Externalist theories of justification, on the other hand, allow that some of the elements necessary for epistemic justification (such as a belief’s being produced by a process that makes it objectively likely to be true) may be cognitively inaccessible to the agent and external to the agent’s perspective.

There are so many varieties of internalism and externalism that further generalization is perilous. Considering the theories’ respective treatments of the problem of induction illustrates the basic difference between them. Hume famously argued that although we rely on inductive inferences, we have access to no non-question begging justification for doing so, as our only grounds for thinking that induction will continue to be reliable is that it always has been reliable. This is an inductive justification of the belief that induction is epistemically justified. If Hume is right, then a typical internalist will concede that beliefs based on inductive reasoning are not epistemically justified. An externalist, however, might insist that such beliefs are justified, provided that inductive reasoning as a matter of fact is a process that reliably produces mostly true beliefs, whether the agent who reasons inductively has access to that fact or not. On the other hand, an epistemic internalist might rate the beliefs of a brain in a vat or a victim of Cartesian evil demon deception as epistemically justified, provided that they were formed in a way that seems reasonable from the point of the view of the agent (the brain in a vat), such as through the careful consideration of evidence (evidence, albeit, that is misleading). The epistemic externalist, however, likely would rate such an agent’s beliefs as unjustified, on the basis of evidence not accessible to the agent, such as that the belief-forming processes she relies on make her beliefs extremely likely to be false.

For the most part, internalist accounts of knowledge are those that appeal to an internalist conception of epistemic justification and externalist accounts of knowledge employ an externalist conception of justification. (Alternatively, one may be an internalist about justification and an externalist about knowledge, by rejecting the view that epistemic justification is one of the requirements for knowledge.) Perhaps the greatest challenge to closure principles for knowledge comes from externalist theories of knowledge, notably those of Robert Nozick and Fred Dretske.

b. Nozick’s Tracking Account of Knowledge and the Failure of Closure

It strikes many that some version of the closure principle must be true. The idea that no version of the principle is true is, according to one noted epistemologist, “one of the least plausible ideas to come down the philosophical pike in recent years.” (Feldman 1995) Nevertheless, philosophers have argued against the epistemic closure principle on many different grounds. One serious challenge to closure arose from those who proposed the “tracking” analysis of knowledge (notably Nozick 1981). According to the tracking theory, to know that p is to track the truth of p. That is, one’s true belief that p is knowledge if and only if the following two conditions hold: if p were not the case, one would not believe that p, and if p were the case, one would believe that p. For one’s belief that p to be knowledge, one’s belief must be sensitive to the truth or falsity of p; that sensitivity is captured by the two subjunctive conditions above. One knows that Albany is the capital of New York only if one would not believe it if it were false, and would believe it if it were true. (See also Robert Nozick’s epistemology).

This is an externalist theory of knowledge because whether or not an agent satisfies the subjunctive conditions for knowledge may not be cognitively accessible to the agent. To evaluate an agent’s belief, with respect to whether it meets those conditions, it may be necessary to adopt the point of view of someone with information not accessible to the agent.

Let’s illustrate this with an example similar to Nozick’s own (1981, 207). Let p be the belief that one is sitting in a chair in Jerusalem. Let q be the belief that one’s brain is not floating in a tank on Alpha Centauri, being artificially stimulated so as to make one believe one is sitting in a chair in Jerusalem. Suppose one has a true belief that p. In the “closest” counterfactual situations (to employ the terminology of one account of truth-conditions for subjunctives) in which p is false (say, one is standing in Jerusalem, or one is sitting in Tel Aviv), one will not believe p. In close counterfactual situations in which one is sitting in Jerusalem, one does believe that p. One’s belief of p tracks the truth of p and thus counts as knowledge.

Suppose, on the other hand, that one has a true belief that q. If one’s belief that q were false, however (and one really was in this predicament on Alpha Centauri), one would still believe (falsely) that one was not in Alpha Centauri (q). One’s belief that q, while actually true, does not track the truth of q (being held when q is true but not when q is false). Hence, the belief that q does not count as knowledge.

How does this relate to the closure of knowledge? The proposition that one is sitting in Jerusalem (p) entails that one’s brain is not floating in a tank in Alpha Centauri, being stimulated so as to make one think that one is sitting in Jerusalem (q). We may suppose that one can correctly deduce q from p. Even so, since one’s belief that p tracks the truth of p and counts as knowledge and one’s belief that q does not do so, knowledge fails to be closed under known entailment. One may know that p, and know that p entails q (and come to believe the latter by correctly deducing it from the former), and yet fail to know that q.

Nozick’s account has at least two virtues. One is that the tracking analysis of knowledge is plausible. The other is that the rejection of closure allows us to reconcile the following two claims, both of which seem plausible but had seemed incompatible: (1) we do know many common sense propositions, such as that I have hands, and (2) we do not know that skeptical hypotheses, such as that I am a handless, artificially stimulated brain in a vat, are false. One desideratum of a theory of knowledge is that it refutes skepticism while accounting for the plausibility and persuasiveness of the skeptic’s case against common sense knowledge claims. Both the skeptic and the Moorean anti-skeptic come up short here. The skeptic must deny our common sense knowledge claims and the Moorean must maintain that we can know the falsity of skeptical hypotheses. As long as we accept the closure principle, whether we are skeptics or anti-skeptics, we cannot maintain both that we know common sense propositions and that we do not know that the skeptical hypotheses are false, since we know that the common sense propositions entail the falsity of the skeptical propositions. Knowledge of the truth of the common sense claims would, if knowledge is closed under known entailment, guarantee our knowledge that skeptical hypotheses are false. Citing our failure to know that skeptical hypotheses are false, the skeptic applies modus tollens and infers that we must not know the common sense propositions. The rejection of closure blocks this move by the skeptic.

This is not to say that there are not plausible counterexamples to the tracking account of knowledge. I may know my mother is not the assassin since she was with me when the assassination took place. But counterfactually, if she were the assassin, I would still believe she was not, since after all I couldn’t believe such a thing of my mother. My belief that my mother is not the assassin fails to track the truth, since I would have believed it even if it were false, but it seems quite plausible that I do know she’s not the assassin, as my evidence for her innocence is quite overwhelming – my mother cannot be in two places at once. Tracking accounts like Nozick’s, which do not make reference to the reasons the agent has for the belief in question, seem vulnerable to such counterexamples.

c. Dretske’s Externalist Account of Knowledge and Closure Failure

Dretske’s account of knowledge is as follows: one’s true belief that p on the basis of reason R is knowledge that p if only if (i) one’s belief that p is based on R and (ii) R would not hold if p were false. Less formally, we may put this as follows: one knows a given claim to be true only if one has a reason to believe that it is true, and one would not have this reason to believe it if it were not true. (See Dretske 1971). This is an externalist account because whether an agent meets conditions (i) and (ii) above may be inaccessible to the agent. One could believe a claim on the basis of a particular reason without being able to explain one’s reliance on that reason, and without knowing whether one would still have the reason if the claim were false. For instance, one might believe that one’s toes are curled on the basis of proprioceptive evidence (evidence that one would not have if one’s toes were not curled), without one having any idea what proprioception is, what sort of evidence one has for the claim that one’s toes are curled, or whether one would have such evidence even if one’s toes were uncurled.

Let’s illustrate Dretske’s account with his famous zebra example (Dretske 1970). Suppose one is in front of the zebra display at the zoo. One believes that one is seeing zebras on the basis of perceptual evidence. Furthermore, in the closest possible worlds in which one is not seeing zebras (where the display is of camels or tigers), one would not have that perceptual evidence. Consequently, one knows that one is now seeing zebras, on the basis of the perceptual evidence one is having. Consider, however, the belief that one is not now seeing mules cleverly disguised by zoo staff to resemble zebras. Whatever one’s reason for believing this claim (say, that it is just very unlikely that the zoo would deceive people in that fashion), one would still have this reason even if the belief were false (and one was seeing mules cleverly disguised to look like zebras). Hence, one would not know that one is not now seeing mules cleverly disguised to resemble zebras.

As with Nozick’s account, this provides a counterexample to the closure of knowledge. One can know that one is now seeing zebras, one can correctly deduce from this that one is not now seeing mules cleverly disguised to resemble zebras, and yet fail to know that one is not now seeing mules cleverly disguised to resemble zebras. Furthermore, Dretske’s account better handles the counterexample to Nozick’s theory. One believes (truly) that one’s mother is not the assassin, on the grounds that one was with one’s mother at the time the assassination happened (and that mother cannot be in two places at once) and one would not have this reason to think mother innocent if she were indeed the assassin. Thus, one knows that one’s mother is not the assassin, since the evidence is absolutely conclusive, despite the fact that if one’s mother were the assassin, one would still believe that she wasn’t, on the basis of a different, bad reason.

Even Dretske’s account is plausibly vulnerable to counterexample. Suppose that one believes correctly at noon on Tuesday that Jones is chair of one’s department, on the basis of the typical sort of evidence (say, recollection of Jones being installed in the position, the department’s website listing Jones as chair, and so forth). Suppose that at five minutes past noon on Tuesday, Jones is suddenly struck dead by a bolt of lightning (and is consequently no longer chair). Did one know at noon, five minutes prior to the death, that Jones was the chair? Since one would have had that same set of reasons to believe at noon that Jones was chair even in the closest possible worlds in which he was not chair at noon (that is, worlds in which he’d been struck dead by lightning five minutes before noon), one does not actually know at noon that Jones is the chair. Those who find this verdict implausible (that is, those who think one does know on the basis of the typical evidence that Jones is the chair, right up until the moment that Jones suddenly is struck dead and stops being the chair), may find Dretske’s account of knowledge wanting. (The example is adapted from Brueckner and Fiocco 2002).

Further justification of Dretske’s for denying closure is that there are other sentential operators that are not closed under known entailment and behave in many respects like the knowledge operator. (See Dretske 1970). Dretske defines a sentential operator O to be fully penetrating when O(p) is closed under known entailment. That is, O is penetrating if and only if: O(p) entails O(q) if p is known to entail q. “It is true that” is a penetrating operator, since, if p is known to entail q, “it is true that p” must entail “it is true that q”. “It is surprising that” is non-penetrating; although it is surprising that tomatoes are growing on the apple tree, it is not surprising that something is growing on the apple tree. Some operators are semi-penetrating. An operator is semi-penetrating when it penetrates only to a certain subset of a given proposition’s entailments.

For instance, “R is an explanatory reason for” seems to be a semi-penetrating operator. Within a range of cases, if p is known to entail q, then R is an explanatory reason for p entails R is an explanatory reason for q. A reason that explains why Bill and Harold are invited to every party necessarily is a reason why Harold is invited to every party. Similarly, “knows that” seems to penetrate through similar entailments; if one knows that Bill and Harold are invited to every party, then one knows that Harold is invited to every party.

However, “R is an explanatory reason for my painting the walls green” need not entail “R is an explanatory reason for my painting the walls.” Depending on the context, a reason that explains why I painted my walls green may be a reason why I did something entailed by my painting the walls green, such as my not painting the walls red, but may not be a reason why I did something else entailed by my painting the walls green, such as my not wallpapering the walls green. The emphasis is crucial. A reason to paint the walls green is a reason not to paint them red, but may not be a reason to paint rather than wallpaper. A reason to paint the walls green may be a reason not to paint the floor green, but it might be neutral as to the color. Consideration of ordinary demands for reasons shows that emphasis, or other contextual factors, determines a certain range of reasons to be relevant and a certain range irrelevant. The same reason will not suffice to explain each of the following: “I bought tomatoes,” “I bought tomatoes” and “I bought tomatoes”, even though these three sentences entail and are entailed by exactly the same claims, since they are logically equivalent. Dretske says that no fact is an island and that various contextual factors will determine, for each operator, its relevant alternatives (i.e. the negations of the consequents to which the operator penetrates). (See also Contextualism in Epistemology, Chapter 3, on Dretske and the denial of closure).

d. “Abominable Conjunctions”

On the other hand, some philosophers view the closure principle as so obviously true that, rather than reject it to accommodate a given theory of knowledge, they would reject the account of knowledge in order to keep closure. Dretske’s account of knowledge has been much discussed in the philosophical literature. One consequence of this rejection of closure in favor of his account that hardly seems felicitous is that one could truly say, “I know that that animal is a zebra and I know that zebras are not mules, but I don’t know that that animal is not a cleverly disguised mule.” Or, “I know I have hands, and I know that if I have hands I am not handless, but I don’t know that I am not a handless brain in a vat.” Worse yet, “I know it is not a mule, but I don’t know it’s not a cleverly disguised mule.” These claims (“abominable conjunctions,” according to DeRose 1995) sound at best paradoxical and at worst absurd. This seems to point to the extreme plausibility of some form or another of the closure principle.

Dretske (2005a, 17-18) agrees that such statements sound absurd, but maintains that they are true. They may violate conventional conversational expectations and they may be met with incomprehension, but they are not self-contradictory. “Empty” and “flat” are often taken to be absolute concepts (since to be empty is to not contain anything at all and to be flat is to have no bumps), but also context-relative, in that whether a particular item counts as a thing or a bump depends on the context. It sounds a bit strange to say that the warehouse is empty, but has lots of dust, gas molecules, and empty crates in it. The utterance may violate conversational rules, but the utterance might, despite all that, be true, if the concepts of emptiness and flatness are as described. So too with the abominable conjunctions if the attendant conception of knowledge is correct. Philosophers may always appeal to Gricean conversational implicatures to blunt the objection that their view entails absurd claims. Truth and conversational propriety are not one and the same. (Paul Grice is the philosopher most closely associated with the view that communication is guided by various conversational maxims and that some utterances are conversationally inappropriate, even if true, because they invite misunderstanding. For instance, the utterance “Mary insulted her boss and she was fired,” is true even if Mary did not insult her boss until after she was fired, but it would be an inappropriate remark in most contexts, since the listener naturally would conclude that the insult preceded the dismissal. For more on this, see Grice 1989).

John Hawthorne (2005: 30-31) makes two points in reply. First, he says, it is unclear what sort of Gricean mechanism could make it true but conversationally inappropriate to utter “S knew that p and correctly deduced q from p, but did not know that q.” Second, an appeal of this sort can at best explain why we do not utter certain true propositions, but not why we actually believe their negations. Even if it is true that one’s wife is his best friend, it would be inappropriate for him to introduce her to someone as his best friend. But the conversational mechanism at play here could hardly be an explanation for why he believed that his wife was not his best friend (even though she was). Why, if the denial of closure is true but conversationally infelicitous, do so many not only not deny closure in conversations but in fact believe that the closure principle is true?

One might reply that many people, even philosophers, are apt in some situations to mistake what is conversationally appropriate for what is true (as with conditional claims that have false antecedents), so an explanation of why a true claim violates conversational norms might well explain why people believe the negation of the claim.

e. Alternative Anti-Skeptical Strategies Need Not Reject Closure

There are alternative strategies for refuting skepticism that seem to have many of the virtues of the tracking account of knowledge, but do not entail the falsity of closure principles. Contextualism, for example, says that knowledge attributions are sensitive to context, in that a subject S might know a proposition p relative to one context, but simultaneously fail to know that p relative to another context. The contextual factors to which knowledge attributions are taken to be sensitive include things like whether a particular doubt has been raised or acknowledged and the importance of the belief being correct.

In an ordinary context, where skeptical scenarios have not been raised, the standards for knowledge are quite low, but, in contexts in which skeptical doubts have been raised, such as an epistemology class, standards for knowledge have been raised to levels that typically cannot be met. One might know relative to the everyday context that she has hands, but fail to know this relative to the skeptic’s context, because a skeptical scenario has been raised and she cannot rule it out.

Or a true belief with a certain level of justification might count as knowledge as long as it is not terribly important that the belief be correct, but would no longer be knowledge if the stakes were raised. One might know that the bank will be open on Saturday after confirming that the bank has Saturday hours, even if one has not checked whether the bank has changed its hours in the past two weeks, as long as no great harm will befall one if it turns out one is wrong. But if financial ruin will befall one were a check not deposited before Monday, then one’s justification might need to be stronger before it would be correct to say that one knows the bank is open Saturday.

The contextualist then can reconcile the intuitions that it is sometimes correct to attribute to someone knowledge of everyday common sense propositions, despite her inability to rule out skeptical propositions, and that we are sometimes correct in refusing to attribute knowledge of the falsity of a skeptical scenario when the subject is unable to rule out such scenarios. But the contextualist can do this while accepting at least some version of closure. The contextualist says that epistemic closure holds within an epistemic context, but fails inter-contextually. For instance, in the everyday, low epistemic standards context, one knows that one has hands and anything that one can correctly deduce from this claim, such as that one is not a handless being deceived into thinking that one has hands. In the context with much higher epistemic standards, one knows neither that one is not a handless, artificially stimulated brain in a vat, nor (by an application of the closure of knowledge under known entailment) that one has hands. Closure will fail only when it extends across contexts. For instance, if one were to cite one’s knowledge that one has hands (in the ordinary context) as grounds for saying in the heightened context that one knows that the brain in a vat hypothesis is false (as the Moorean might), one would illegitimately apply the closure principle. The skeptic’s citing one’s failure to know the falsity of the skeptical hypothesis (in the heightened context) as entailing that one does not know the common sense proposition (in the ordinary context) would be a similar misuse of the closure principle.

If a theory of knowledge is independently plausible and can answer the skeptic without denying closure, then, everything else being equal, we ought to be reluctant to reject closure just so that we can accept the tracking account of knowledge. Contextualism, of course, is plagued with problems of its own. One such problem is as follows: since whether one knows a claim or not depends on how stringent the epistemic standards are in the context and the standards can be raised by a particular doubt occurring to someone in the context, contextualism seems to imply that it is easier to know things if one spends time with the stupid or incurious or if one is stupid or incurious.

The plausibility of the denial of closure may well depend not only on whether it is a way to avoid skepticism, but on whether it is the only way to do so. (Dretske does insist that the only plausible way to refute skepticism is by denying closure. See his 2005a and 2005b for a defense of this claim, trenchant criticisms of the contextualist theory, and responses to criticisms of the tracking theory.)

f. Some Skeptical Arguments do not Employ Closure

One of the strengths claimed for the tracking account of knowledge is that it blocks the standard skeptical argument, since it involves the rejection of closure. Not all skeptical arguments employ closure principles, however, so it is unclear how much anti-skeptical value would accrue from denying closure. Underdetermination arguments might be the best skeptical arguments and they do not depend (at least explicitly) on closure.

Underdetermination is a relation that holds between two or more theories, when the theories are incompatible, but empirically equivalent. Underdetermination skeptical arguments rely crucially on the premise that if two theories are incompatible but compatible with all the available (and perhaps possible) data, we cannot know that one is true and the other false. Compare, for example, the thesis that I have hands, which I perceive through sense perception, and the thesis that I am a handless brain in a vat, artificially stimulated so as to have misleading sense perceptions. These theses are incompatible, but they are empirically equivalent. Whichever thesis were true, I would have the same sort of experiences. Suppose we adopt the following principle: if two incompatible theses both entail (or predict) the same observational data, then that observational data does not support (or justify belief of) one of the theses over the other. With this principle and the premise that the two theses are incompatible but observationally equivalent, we can deduce that our apparent perception of our hands does not justify us in believing that we have hands.

The argument is greatly oversimplified, but the outline of the skeptical argument from underdetermination now ought to be clear. The argument does not explicitly employ any closure premise, so the rejection of closure would seem not to undermine the argument in any straightforward way. One could always argue that the appeal of the argument from underdetermination implicitly relies on the closure principle or that the argument from underdetermination is objectionable on other grounds. Skeptical arguments from underdetermination, however, seem as plausible as other skeptical arguments and their plausibility seems not to depend on the plausibility of any of the closure principles.

Infinite regress arguments for skepticism also do not straightforwardly appeal to closure. A regress argument that no belief is epistemically justified (and hence than no belief counts as knowledge) runs as follows. We assume that all justification is inferential. That is, every justified belief is justified by appeal to some other justified belief. The basis for this claim might be the nature of argumentation. One is justified in believing a conclusion if one is justified in believing the premises that support the conclusion. If the conclusion is one of the premises, then the argument is question-begging, or circular, and not rationally persuasive. But if every justified belief can be justified only be inferring it from some further justified belief and there cannot be an infinite regress of justified beliefs, then it must be that no beliefs are justified. (A foundationalist about justification, on the other hand, while agreeing that an infinite regress of justified beliefs is impossible, insists that there are justified beliefs, and hence that some beliefs are justified non-inferentially, or in other words, that some justified beliefs are basic or foundational). The claim that no justified belief is self-justifying does not entail any closure principle of justification or knowledge, so the argument seems to be independent of closure and thus not vulnerable to arguments against closure principles. (See also Ancient Skepticism).

The proponent of the tracking account of knowledge need not answer all forms of the skeptical argument with the same tools, so even if some skeptical arguments do not depend on the closure principle, the tracking analysis might provide the resources for countering the skeptical arguments from underdetermination or regress.

4. Dogmatism and the Rejection of Closure

At least one philosopher (Audi 1988, 76-8; 1991, 77-84) has claimed that the justification of dogmatism, adapted from Harman (see section 2 of this article), is a reductio ad absurdum of the epistemic closure principle. If closure allows one to infer, and thus know, that any evidence against something one knows must be misleading and may be ignored, then closure must be rejected.

Audi’s example is of a man who adds up a series of numbers and thereby knows the sum of the numbers. But the man’s wife (whom he considers to be a better mathematician) says that he has added the numbers incorrectly and gotten the wrong sum. If the man knows that the sum is n, and knows that his wife says the sum is not n, then by closure he knows that his wife is wrong. (This is so, as “the sum is n and my wife says the sum in not n” entails that “my wife is wrong;” one knows the former claim and knows it entails the latter, so one knows the latter). Since he knows his wife is wrong, there is no need to recalculate the sum. (Similar examples appear in Dretske 1970 and Thalberg 1974). If one believes something only when one takes oneself to know it, as is plausible, then by this reasoning one has reason to dismiss any evidence against something that one believes.

Denying the closure principle to avoid the odd dogmatic conclusion has some initial appeal, but there are alternative solutions that do not require us to reject such a compelling principle. And, as Feldman says (1995, 493), there is a general reason not to resolve the paradox by denying closure. To say, “Yes, I know that p is true, and that p entails q, but I draw the line at q,” seems irrational. To refuse to accept what you know to be the consequences of your beliefs, he says, is to be “patently unreasonable.” Not only is it infelicitous to deny closure, but the dogmatist argument may be blocked without doing so.

For instance, one could take the dogmatism argument to be a reductio ad absurdum of the anti-skeptical position. This is the tack taken by Peter Unger (1975). If we deny that one could know that p (say, that the sum of the numbers is n), then even if we accept closure, we have no reason to suppose that one could know that all evidence against p was misleading.

Alternatively, Roy Sorensen (Sorensen 1988) argues that given that one knows that p, the conditional “If E is evidence against p, then E is misleading” is a junk conditional, in that although it may be known to be true, this knowledge cannot be expanded under modus ponens. That is to say, if “if p then q” is a junk conditional, the conditional can be known to be true, but it could not be the case that simultaneously the conditional is known and that knowledge of the antecedent p would justify one in believing the consequent q. Some conditionals are known to be true on the basis of the extreme unlikelihood of the antecedent, but are such that if one acquired evidence that supports the antecedent, one would not be justified in inferring the consequent because the probability of the antecedent is inversely proportional to the probability of the conditional. That is, if one were to learn that the antecedent of the conditional was true, one would no longer have reason to accept (and would no longer know) the conditional. “If this is a Cuban cigar, then I’m a monkey’s uncle!” is an example of such a conditional. This conditional can be known to be true, in virtue of the antecedent being known to be false, but if one were to find evidence that this is indeed a Cuban cigar, one should not infer that he is a monkey’s uncle. Rather, one should conclude that perhaps one did not know the conditional to be true after all, since one has evidence that its antecedent was true and its consequent false. In short, if a conditional is a junk conditional one cannot come to know the consequent q in virtue of one’s knowing the antecedent p and the conditional if p then q, because one’s knowledge of the conditional depends on the falsity of the antecedent.

Given that one knows that r (say, that one’s car is in parking lot A), one knows that the conditional “if there is any evidence against r, however strong, then it must be misleading” is true. Part of one’s basis for knowing that r might be that one has reason to believe that there is no strong evidence against r. But if one were to learn of strong evidence against r, such as testimony that one’s car had been towed, one ought, at least in some cases, to consider the possibility that one does not in fact know that r, rather than simply inferring that the testimony is misleading. Learning the truth of the antecedent – that there is strong evidence against r – may undermine the justification for believing the conditional itself, thus making the conditional resistant to modus ponens. Knowledge of the conditional depends on one’s knowing that the antecedent is false. Finding evidence in favor of the antecedent – even if in fact it is misleading – may weaken one’s justification for the conditional, such that one no longer knows the conditional to be true.

This blocking of the dogmatist argument does not involve denying closure, though. The reason the modus ponens inference fails to go through is because the conditional is a “junk” conditional; one can know the conditional to be true only if one does not know the antecedent to be true, and the closure principle applies only if one simultaneously knows both the conditional and its antecedent to be true.

Another explanation that does not require the denial of closure is due to Michael Veber (Veber 2004). He says that even if the dogmatist argument is sound, the principle “If a piece of evidence E is known by S to be misleading, S ought to disregard it,” ought not to be endorsed on grounds of human fallibility. We are frequently enough wrong in taking ourselves to know what we in fact do not know that following such a principle would lead one to disregard evidence that is not misleading. There is nothing wrong with the principle, provided it is correctly applied; but due to the difficulty or impossibility of correctly applying it, adopting such a policy is contraindicated.

5. The McKinsey Paradox, Closure, and Transmission Failure

a. The McKinsey Paradox

Michael McKinsey (1991) discovered a paradox about content externalism that has prompted some reconsideration of how knowledge is transmitted through deductive reasoning.

Content externalism (or anti-individualism) is, to greatly oversimplify, the thesis that we are only able to have thoughts with certain contents because we inhabit environments of certain sorts. (Putnam 1975 and Burge 1979 are the most notable defenses of this view). Molecule-for-molecule duplicates could differ in their contents due to differences in their environments. According to the externalist, my twin on Twin Earth might be an exact duplicate of me, but if Twin Earth contains a different but similar light metal used to make baseball bats, cans, and so forth instead of aluminum, then even if the denizens of Twin Earth call this metal “aluminum,” their thoughts are not thoughts about aluminum. This view is a repudiation of the Cartesian view of the mental, according to which the contents of our thoughts are what they are independent of the surrounding world.

Externalism has been defended and criticized on many different grounds, but the debate about externalism has pivoted largely on its implications for the thesis that we have privileged access to the contents of our own thoughts. How does one know that she is now thinking that some cans are made from aluminum, rather than the thought that some cans are made from twaluminum (as we may call it), which is what she would be thinking if she lived on Twin Earth? Incompatibilists about externalism and privileged access point out that the two thoughts are introspectively indiscriminable if externalism is true and argue that one could only know which of these thoughts one is now thinking through empirical investigation of one’s environment.

Compatibilists about externalism and self-knowledge often argue that if a subject has a mental state with a particular content (say, a belief that some cans are made of aluminum) in virtue of that subject bearing a certain relation to an external state of affairs (say, aluminum, rather than twaluminum, being present in one’s environs), then any mental state the subject has about that particular mental state of his, like his belief that he believes some cans are made of aluminum, will also stand in a similar relation to the same external state of affairs (aluminum, rather than twaluminum, being present). Hence, this second-order mental state (i.e. a mental state about a mental state) will involve the same content as the first-order belief (say, that some cans are made of aluminum). In short, one will believe that he believes cans are made of aluminum only if one in fact does believe that cans are made of aluminum, since both of these states bear a causal relation to aluminum, rather than twaluminum. (See Burge 1988 and Heil 1988). Whatever makes it the case that S thinks that p (instead of q) will also make it the case that S thinks I am thinking that p (instead of I am thinking that q). Coupled with a reliabilist theory of knowledge, these second-order beliefs count as knowledge since they cannot go wrong and the thesis of privileged access is reconciled with externalism.

Enter McKinsey’s Paradox. We assume that we know content externalism to be true and that it is compatible with a suitably robust thesis of privileged access to thought contents. We may now reason as follows:

1. I know that I am in mental state M (say, the state of believing that water is wet). (Privileged Access)
2. I know that if I am in mental state M, then I meet external conditions E (say, living in an environment that contains water). (Content Externalism, known through philosophical reflection)
3. If I know one thing and I know that it entails a second thing, then I know the second thing. (Closure of knowledge under known entailment)
4. Thus, I know that I meet external conditions E. (From 1-3)

The knowledge attributed in the premises is a priori in the broad sense that includes knowledge gotten through introspection and/or philosophical reflection. That knowledge is not gained via empirical investigation of the external world. The conclusion follows by an application of the closure principle. What is paradoxical is that, given closure, it seems that one can know the truth of an empirical claim about the external world (say, that one’s environment contains water or that it contains aluminum rather than twaluminum) simply by inferring it from truths known by reflection or introspection. This argument bolsters the incompatibilist’s case: since it is only by investigation of the world that one can know that one meets a particular set of external conditions and since the premises (including closure) entail that this fact can be known on the basis of knowledge not dependent on investigation of the world, either the privileged access premise or the externalist thesis must be false (provided that the closure principle is correct).

b. Davies, Wright, and the Closure/Transmission Distinction

There are many responses to this argument. Some reject externalism, some (like McKinsey) deny privileged access, and some compatibilists (Brueckner 1992) argue that even if externalism is known to be true, nothing as specific as the second premise of the argument could be known a priori. But perhaps the most influential attempt to solve the paradox is due to Martin Davies (1998) and Crispin Wright (2000). They argue that even though arguments like McKinsey’s are valid and their premises are known to be true, this knowledge is not transmitted across the entailment to the conclusion. At first blush, it seems like Davies and Wright are rejecting closure, which is certainly one way to deal with the paradox. Davies and Wright accept closure, though, and only reject a related but stronger epistemological principle that says that knowledge is transmitted over known entailment.

Davies and Wright are distinguishing between the closure of knowledge under known entailment and what they take to be a common misreading of it. The closure principle says that if one knows that p and knows that p entails q, then one knows that q, but the principle is silent on what one’s basis or justification for q is and does not claim that the basis for q is the knowledge that p and that p entails q. The principle of the transmission of knowledge under known entailment, however, states that if one knows that p, and knows that p entails q, then one knows q on that basis – what enables one to know that p and that p entails q also enables one to know that q. Davies and Wright accept the closure principle but deny the transmission principle, arguing that it fails when the inference from p to q is, although valid, not cogent. Here cogency is understood as an argument’s aptness for producing rational conviction.

One way an argument could be valid but fail to be cogent is that the justification for the premises presupposes the truth of the conclusion. If I reason from the premise that I have a drivers license issued by the state of North Carolina (based on visual inspection of my license and memory of having obtained it at the North Carolina Department of Motor Vehicles) to the conclusion that there exists an external world, including North Carolina, outside my mind, it is plausible that my justification for the premise (taking sense experience and memory at face value) presupposes the truth of the conclusion. If this is so, then it seems that the premise could not be my basis for knowing the conclusion. Anyone in doubt about the conclusion would not accept the premise, so although the premise entails the conclusion, the premise could not provide the basis for rational conviction that the conclusion is true. Such an argument is valid, but not cogent. It would not be a counterexample to closure, for anyone who knows the premise and the entailment also must know the conclusion, but it is a counterexample to the transmission principle, since the conclusion would not be known on the basis of the knowledge of the premise.

According to Davies and Wright, the McKinsey argument is valid but not cogent because knowledge of the conclusion is presupposed in one’s supposed introspective knowledge of the premises. Thus, it is a counterexample to transmission, but poses no threat to closure. The non-empirical access to the externally individuated thought contents is conditional on the assumption that certain external conditions obtain (such as that one’s environs include aluminum rather than twaluminum), which can only be confirmed empirically. Thus one may not reason from the non-empirical knowledge claimed in the premises to non-empirical knowledge of an empirical truth that enjoys presuppositional status with regard to the premises. That one has a thought about water may entail that one bears a causal relation to water in one’s environment (if externalism is correct) and one may know the former and the entailment only if one knows the latter, but one may not cogently reason from the premise to the conclusion, since the inference begs the question. Anyone who doubts the conclusion of the McKinsey argument in the first place would not (or at least should not — the presuppositions of our premises are not always recognized as such) be moved to accept the premises that entail it.

Consider then the following principle about a priori knowledge:

(APK) If a subject knows something a priori and correctly deduces (a priori) from it a second thing, then the subject knows a priori the second claim.

We can describe this principle in two equivalent ways. It is the principle of closure of a priori knowledge under correct a priori deduction and, alternatively, it is a specific instance of the principle of transmission of knowledge under known entailment, since it claims that the a priori basis for knowledge of the premise transmits to the conclusion, allowing it to be known a priori as well. If Davies and Wright are correct, the principle is false because counterexamples may be found in deductions that are valid but not cogent.

Davies and Wright apply this distinction between transmission and closure to Moore’s anti-skeptical argument as well. Although it is true that the negation of the brain-in-a-vat hypothesis is entailed by an ordinary proposition, such as that I have hands, the existence of the external world is presupposed in the justification for that premise and, therefore, may not be justifiably inferred from that premise. Moore’s argument is not cogent, so it is a counterexample to transmission, which we have reason to reject anyhow, and not a counterexample to closure (or so Davies and Wright argue).

This is plausibly another sort of conditional that is not expandable by modus ponens. Unlike the junk conditionals, which cannot be expanded because the conditional can be known to be true only when the antecedent of the conditional is not known to be true, conditionals in which the justification for the antecedent presupposes justification for the consequent – we may call them conditionals of presupposition – cannot be expanded because the relevant modus ponens inference would not be cogent. The inference would be question-begging.

The distinction that Davies and Wright argue for also applies to closure principles for justified belief. If they are correct, then justified belief could be closed under known entailment even if justification is not necessarily transmitted across known entailment. The counterexamples to the transmission principle for knowledge would also function as counterexamples for the transmissibility of justified belief.

Some have argued that the Davies-Wright line of argument fails to solve the McKinsey paradox. Whether they are right is beyond the scope of this entry. But the distinction Davies and Wright have drawn between transmission and closure is an important one. That if one knows that p and has validly deduced q from p, one must know that q, tells us nothing about one’s basis for q. Although quite often it can and will, in some instances knowledge of p cannot provide the basis for knowledge of q, even though p entails q, because the justification for p presupposes q. One knows that q (on some independent basis), so there is no counterexample to closure, but q will not be known on the basis of p, so the transmission principle is false.

Clarifying the closure principle as a principle about the distribution of knowledge across known entailment, rather than as a principle about the transmission or acquisition of knowledge, divorces the closure principle, to some extent, from the initial intuitive support for it, which is the idea that we can add to our store of knowledge (or justified belief) by accepting what we know to be entailed by propositions we know (or justifiably believe). On this understanding of closure, knowledge and justified belief are distributed across known entailment even when drawing the inference in question could not add to one’s store of knowledge or justified belief.

6. Ordinary Propositions, Lottery Propositions, and Closure

The closure principle also figures in a paradox about our knowledge of “ordinary propositions” and “lottery propositions.” Ordinary propositions are those that we ordinarily suppose ourselves to know. Lottery propositions are those with a high likelihood of being true, but which we are ordinarily disinclined to say that we know. Suppose that one lives on a fixed income and struggles to make ends meet. It seems that one knows one will not be able to afford a mansion on the French Riviera this year. One’s not being able to afford the mansion this year entails that one will not win the big lottery this year. By the closure principle, since one knows that one will not be able to afford the mansion and one knows that one’s not being able to afford the mansion entails that one will not win the lottery, one must know that one will not win the lottery. Most, however, are disinclined to say that one could know that one will not win the lottery. There’s always a chance, after all (provided that one buys a ticket).

This phenomenon is widespread. Ordinarily, one who keeps up with politics could be said to know that Dick Cheney is the U.S. Vice-President. That Cheney is the Vice-President entails that Cheney did not die of a heart attack thirty seconds ago. But it seems that one does not know that Cheney did not die of a heart attack in the last thirty seconds. How could one know such a thing? (The coining of the term “lottery proposition” and the discovery that this phenomenon is widespread, is due to Jonathan Vogel).

The apparently inconsistent triad is (i) one knows the ordinary proposition, (ii) one fails to know the lottery proposition, and (iii) closure. One may eliminate the inconsistency by denying closure on the sort of grounds that Dretske and Nozick cite. Plausibly, one’s belief of so-called ordinary propositions tracks the truth, while one’s belief of lottery propositions does not. If Cheney were not Vice-President, one would not believe he was, but had Cheney died in the past thirty seconds, one still would believe he was Vice-President.

One might bite the skeptical bullet and insist that one really does not know that Cheney is Vice-President. One of a more anti-skeptical bent might maintain that one can really know the lottery propositions, such as that Cheney did not die in the last thirty seconds. Such a resolution has considerable costs, but denying closure is not among them.

Alternatively, one might argue for a contextualist handling of the problem that does not require the denial of closure or biting the skeptical or anti-skeptical bullet.

7. References and Further Reading

a. References

• Audi, Robert (1988), Belief, Justification and Knowledge, Belmont: Wadsworth.
  • Argues against closure to avoid dogmatic conclusion.
• Audi, Robert (1991), “Justification, Deductive Closure and Reasons to Believe,” Dialogue, 30: 77-84.
  • Argues against closure to avoid dogmatic conclusion.
• Brueckner, Anthony (1992), “What an Anti-Individualist Knows A Priori,” Analysis 52: 111-118.
  • Solution to the McKinsey paradox that does not deny closure.
• Brueckner, Anthony (2004), “Strategies for Refuting Closure,” Analysis 64: 333-35.
  • Reply to Warfield 2004 and Hales 1995.
• Brueckner, Anthony; Fiocco, M. Oreste (2002), “Williamson’s Anti-Luminosity Argument,” Philosophical Studies, 110: 285-293.
  • Contains putative counterexample to Dretskean account of knowledge.
• Burge, Tyler (1979), “Individualism and the Mental,” Midwest Studies in Philosophy, 4: 73-122.
  • Seminal defense of content externalism (or anti-individualism).
• Burge, Tyler (1988), “Individualism and Self-Knowledge,” The Journal of Philosophy, 85: 649-663.
  • Influential reconciliation of content externalism and the privileged access theses.
• Davies, Martin (1998), “Externalism, Architecturalism, and Epistemic Warrant,” in C. MacDonald, B. Smith and C. J. G. Wright (eds.), 321-361.
  • Argues that McKinsey paradox is a counterexample to transmission, not closure.
• Dretske, Fred (1970), “Epistemic Operators,” The Journal of Philosophy, 67: 1007-1023.
  • Seminal paper arguing against the closure of knowledge.
• Dretske, Fred (1971), “Conclusive Reasons,” Australasian Journal of Philosophy, 49: 1-22.
  • Contains Dretske’s account of knowledge.
• Dretske, Fred (2005a), “The Case against Closure,” in Steup and Sosa (eds.), 13-26.
  • Argues that denying closure is only way to avoid skepticism.
• Dretske, Fred (2005b), “Reply to Hawthorne,” in Steup and Sosa (eds.), 43-46.
  • Reply to Hawthorne 2005.
• Feldman, Richard (1995), “In Defence of Closure,” The Philosophical Quarterly, 45: 487-494.
  • Defends closure against Audi’s arguments (Audi 1988, 1991).
• Grice, Paul (1989), Studies in the Ways of Words, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
  • Classic treatment of pragmatic/semantic distinction, and conversational maxims and implicatures. Relevant to discussion of the tracking theory of knowledge’s “abominable conjunctions.”
• Gunderson, Keith (ed.) (1975), Language, Mind and Knowledge, Minnesota Studies in the Philosophy of Science, volume VII, Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press.
  • Contains seminal Putnam 1975 article.
• Hales, Steven (1995), “Epistemic Closure Principles,” The Southern Journal of Philosophy 33: 185-201.
  • Produces counterexamples to many different formulations of the closure principle, but points out that one cannot refute closure for knowledge by showing that some necessary condition for knowledge fails to be closed.
• Harman, Gilbert (1973), Thought, Princeton: Princeton University Press.
  • Employs closure principle in formulating dogmatic argument.
• Hawthorne, John (2004), Knowledge and Lotteries, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Argues for quasi-contextualist solution to problem of lottery propositions, and defends closure.
• Hawthorne, John (2005), “The Case for Closure,” in Steup and Sosa (eds.), 26-43.
  • Defends closure against Dretske’s 2005a arguments.
• Heil, John (1988), “Privileged Access,” Mind 97: 238-251.
  • Influential reconciliation of content externalism and privileged access theses.
• MacDonald, Cynthia; Smith, Barry; Wright, Crispin (1998), Knowing Our Own Minds: Essays on Self-Knowledge, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Contains the Davies 1998 article.
• McKinsey, Michael (1991), “Anti-Individualism and Privileged Access,” Analysis 51: 9-16.
  • Formulation of the McKinsey paradox.
• Moore, G.E. (1959), Philosophical Papers, London: George Allen and Unwin, Ltd.
  • Contains seminal anti-skeptical essays, such as “Proof of an External World,” and “A Defence of Common Sense.”
• Nozick, Robert (1981), Philosophical Explanations, Cambridge: Harvard University Press.
  • Influential tracking account of knowledge and consequent denial of closure.
• Putnam, Hilary (1975), “The Meaning of ‘Meaning’,” in K. Gunderson (ed.), 131-193.
  • Seminal work defending content externalism.
• Roth, Michael (ed.) (1990), Doubting: Contemporary Perspectives on Skepticism, Dordrecht: Kluwer.
  • Contains Vogel 1990.
• Sorensen, Roy (1988), “Dogmatism, Junk Knowledge and Conditionals,” The Philosophical Quarterly, 38: 433-454.
  • Solves dogmatism puzzle without denying closure.
• Steup, Matthias, and Sosa, Ernest, (eds.) (2005), Contemporary Debates in Epistemology, Malden MA: Blackwell Publishing.
  • Contains Dretske-Hawthorne exchange on closure.
• Thalberg, Irving (1974), “Is Justification Transmissible Through Deduction?” Philosophical Studies 25: 347-356.
  • Argues for counterexample to closure in dogmatism examples.
• Unger, Peter (1975), Ignorance: A Case for Scepticism, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Retains closure but offers skeptical resolution of the dogmatism puzzle.
• Veber, Michael (2004), “What do you do with Misleading Evidence?” The Philosophical Quarterly 54: 557-569.
  • Reply to Sorensen (1988) and alternative solution to dogmatism puzzle.
• Vogel, Jonathan (1990), “Are There Counterexamples to the Closure Principle?” in M. Roth (ed.).
  • Influential discussion of closure and lottery propositions.
• Wright, Crispin (2000), “Cogency and Question-Begging: Some reflections of McKinsey’s Paradox and Putnam’s Proof,” Philosophical Issues 10: 140-163.
  • On the distinction between closure and transmission, and McKinsey’s paradox.

b. Further Reading

• Brueckner, Anthony (1985), “Transmission for Knowledge not Established,” The Philosophical Quarterly 35: 193-95.
  • Reply to Forbes 1984.
• Brueckner, Anthony (2000), “Klein on Closure and Skepticism,” Philosophical Studies 98: 139-151.
  • Reply to Klein 1995.
• DeRose, Keith (1995), “Solving the Skeptical Problem,” Philosophical Review 104: 1-52.
  • Influential defense of contextualist epistemology.
• Forbes, Graeme (1984), “Nozick on Scepticism,” The Philosophical Quarterly 34: 43-52.
  • Argues that Nozick’s denial of closure cannot adequately handle cases of inferential knowledge.
• Goldman, Alvin (1976), “Discrimination and Perceptual Knowledge,” Journal of Philosophy 73: 771-791.
  • Defends reliabilist account of knowledge that denies closure, and contains a helpful discussion of the notion of a relevant alternative.
• Klein, Peter (1981), Certainty: A Refutation of Skepticism, Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press.
  • Argues that defense of knowledge closure assumes internalism about justification, so the skeptic who uses the principle begs the question against the externalist anti-skeptic.
• Klein, Peter (1995), “Skepticism and Closure: Why the Evil Genius Argument Fails,” Philosophical Topics 23: 213-236.
  • Offers a defense of closure for justification, which, whether the defense succeeds or fails, he says refutes the skeptic.
• Luper (-Foy), Steven, (1987), “The Causal Indicator Analysis of Knowledge,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 47: 563-587.
  • Argues for a tracking account of knowledge that retains closure.
• Pritchard, Duncan (2002), “McKinsey Paradoxes, Radical Scepticism, and the Transmission of Knowledge Across Known Entailments,” Synthese 130: 279-302.
  • Reply to Martin and Davies on Transmission and McKinsey paradox.
• Salmon, Nathan (1989), “Illogical Belief,” Philosophical Perspectives 3: 243-285.
  • Argues that his Millian account of names and belief produces counterexamples to closure principles of justification and knowledge.
• Silins, Nicholas (2005), “Transmission Failure Failure,” Philosophical Studies 126: 71-102.
  • Argues against the Davies-Wright line on transmission failure.
• Sosa, Ernest (1999), “How to Defeat Opposition to Moore,” Philosophical Perspectives 13: 141-152.
  • Adjustment of the tracking account of knowledge that allows it to sustain closure.
• Stine, Gail (1971), “Dretske on Knowing the Logical Consequences,” Journal of Philosophy 68: 296-299.
  • Reply to Dretske 1970.
• Warfield, Ted (2004), “When Epistemic Closure Does and Does not Fail: a Lesson from the History of Epistemology,” Analysis 64: 35-41.
  • Points out that one cannot refute closure for knowledge by showing that some necessary condition for knowledge fails to be closed.

Author Information

John M. Collins
Email: collinsjo@ecu.edu
East Carolina University
U. S. A.