Śāntideva (fl. 8th c.)

Śāntideva (literally “god of peace”) was the name given to an Indian Mahāyāna Buddhist philosopher-monk, known as the author of two texts, the Bodhicaryāvatāra and the Śikṣāsamuccaya. These works both express the ideal of the bodhisattva — the ideal person of Mahāyāna Buddhism. The term Mahāyāna, literally “Great Vehicle,” came into use to mean the idea of attempting to become a bodhisattva (and eventually a buddha) oneself, rather than merely following the teachings set out by Siddhārtha Gautama (considered the original Buddha). This was the earliest usage of the term mahāyāna in Sanskrit, although even by Śāntideva’s time, understandings of what becoming a bodhisattva involved had undergone many changes; the Mahāyāna had come to be understood as a separate school rather than as a vocation (see Nattier 2003; Harrison 1987).

Both of Śāntideva’s texts explore the bodhisattva ideal as an ethical one, in that they prescribe how a person should properly live, and provide reasons for living in that way. Śāntideva’s close attention to ethics makes him relatively unusual among Indian philosophers, for whom metaphysics (or theoretical philosophy more generally) was more typically the primary concern. Śāntideva’s ethical thought is widely known, cited  and loved among Tibetan Buddhists, and is increasingly coming to the attention of Western thinkers. Śāntideva’s metaphysics is of interest primarily because of its close connection to his ethics.

Table of Contents

1. History and Works
   1. Writings
   2. Life
   3. Reception and Influence
2. The Progress of the Bodhisattva
3. Excellence in Means
4. Good and Bad Karma
5. The Perfections
   1. Giving
      1. Giving as Giving Up
      2. Upward Gifts: Expressing Esteem
      3. Downward Gifts: Attracting Others
   2. Good Conduct
   3. Patient Endurance
      1. Happiness from Enduring Suffering
      2. The Case Against Anger
   4. Heroic Strength
   5. Meditation
      1. Equalization of Self and Other
      2. Exchange of Self and Other
      3. Meditations Against the Three Poisons
   6. Metaphysical Insight
      1. Content
      2. Practical Implications
6. References and Further Reading
   1. Primary Works
   2. Translations Cited
   3. General Studies of Śāntideva
   4. Specialized Studies
   5. Related Interest

1. History and Works

a. Writings

The name “Śāntideva” is associated above all with two extant texts: the Bodhicaryāvatāra (hereafter BCA) and the Śikṣāsamuccaya (hereafter ŚS). The Bodhicaryāvatāra (often rendered “Guide to the Bodhisattva’s Way of Life”), in its most widely known form, is a work of just over 900 verses. Tibetan legends suggest that the text was originally recited orally (see de Jong 1975), as do the text’s own literary features. Although it has been translated into Tibetan multiple times and is revered throughout Tibetan Buddhist tradition, it was originally composed and redacted in Sanskrit. Its Sanskrit is relatively close to Pānini’s official standards of grammar, with a Buddhist vocabulary.  Its ten chapters lead their reader through the path to becoming a bodhisattva — which is to say a future Buddha, and therefore a being on the way to perfection, according to Mahāyāna tradition.

The Śikṣāsamuccaya (“Training Anthology”) is a longer prose work in nineteen chapters. The ŚS is organized as a commentary on twenty-seven short mnemonic verses known as the Śikṣāsamuccaya Kārikā (hereafter ŚSK). It consists primarily of quotations (of varying length) from sūtras, authoritative texts considered to be the word of the Buddha — generally those sūtras associated with Mahāyāna tradition. Most scholars have taken the ŚS to be composed almost entirely of such quotations. However, Paul Harrison (2007) has recently claimed that a substantial portion of it is original to the redactor.

Like the BCA, the ŚS was originally composed in Sanskrit, as were the sūtras it quotes. However, while Śāntideva’s own portions are in relatively standard Sanskrit, the quotations are mostly in the heavily vernacularized language usually known as Buddhist Hybrid Sanskrit. It is considerably less accessible to a novice reader than the BCA, and its organization can be bewildering. Richard Mahoney (2002) has recently provided a clear account of the text’s structure, which will be discussed later in this article.

Who were these texts written for? One can infer from the texts that they are intended for an audience of men whose sexual desires are directed toward women, as the auditor’s sexual cravings are always discussed in those terms. Therefore, the use of masculine forms to refer to the implied audience is unproblematic. This auditor also understands Sanskrit, and lives in or after the seventh century CE. His knowledge of Sanskrit implies, at the least, that he is well educated, and therefore well versed in the ideas of classical Sanskritic culture. And he is not necessarily on the bodhisattva path when he begins reading or hearing the texts, but is motivated to enter that path by studying them.

The texts’ implied audience includes monks, and may also include householders (nonmonks). While monks are a significant component of the text’s implied audience (Onishi 2003), and are in some respects the ideal audience, they are not necessarily the only such audience. The principles of conduct put forth in the BCA’s fifth chapter resemble those of vinaya monastic codes, and indeed some of them have been taken directly from the prātimokṣa monastic rule books (Crosby and Skilton 1995, 32), but few of them would be impossible or absurd for a householder to follow. In the ŚS, too, Śāntideva certainly considers monasticism better and more praiseworthy than the householder life, but part of his task is to convince householding readers to pursue the monastic life. He claims that “in every birth the great bodhisattva goes forth [as a monk] . . . from the household life” (ŚS 14). But this is a process renewed in every lifetime, beginning with the household life; and Śāntideva does refer on multiple occasions to householding bodhisattvas (for example at ŚS 120 and 267). This text, then, is addressed in part to householders.

b. Life

Tibetan hagiographic histories (Bu ston, Tāranātha, Ye shes dPal ‘byor and Sum pa mKhan po) provide the most detailed accounts of Śāntideva’s life, although most contemporary historians doubt their veracity. In brief, they tell of a prince from Saurāstra (in contemporary Gujarat) who joined the great monastic university of Nālandā. His fellow monks, unaware of his wisdom, saw only a lazy man unworthy of their company. To prove his presumed lack of knowledge, they asked him to recite a Buddhist sūtra text. Śāntideva, undaunted, asked whether they would like to hear something old or something new. Asked for something new, he proceeded to recite the BCA. When he reached verse IX.34 — “When neither an entity nor a nonentity remain before thought, then thought, with no object, is pacified because it has no other destination” — he rose into the air and his body disappeared. The remainder of the text was recited by a disembodied voice. The written text of the ŚS, the voice told the audience, could be found in Śāntideva’s room, along with a text called the Sūtrasamuccaya (Pezzali 1968, 4-20). There is some debate among scholars as to the nature of the latter work, but all agree that the title does not refer to any additional surviving work of Śāntideva’s, and that the BCA and ŚS constitute his extant corpus (see Lele 2007, 17n8).

Beyond the hagiographies, most of what we know of Śāntideva comes from the ideas found in extant recensions of his texts. This article treats Śāntideva’s works together, as the works of a single author, as Indian and Tibetan Buddhist tradition has always done; similarly, it refers to the ideas found in the canonical Sanskrit recensions of the texts, not to the Tibetan or to the BCA recension found at Dunhuang. Since the article’s approach is to examine the ideas of this author, Śāntideva, it spends relatively little time on the structure of each of his two texts as separate units. For an overview of the relevant textual issues and a defense of this article’s approach to the texts, see Lele 2007, 9-31. More specifically, for a discussion of the Dunhuang recension, see Saito 1993. For discussions of the structure of the BCA, see Crosby and Skilton 1995; Saito 1993. For discussions of the structure of the ŚS, see Clayton 2006; Griffiths 1999, 133-43; Hedinger 1984; Mahoney 2002; Mrozik 2007. On both, see Pezzali 1968.

It is difficult to learn much about the texts’ historical composer, or their redactor, beyond what is found in the texts themselves. As noted, Tibetan historians recount the life story of a Śāntideva identified as the texts’ author, but it is difficult to sort fact from legend with so little corroborating evidence. There seems little reason to doubt that someone by the name of Śāntideva wrote some portion of the two texts, or that he was a monk at Nālandā. (The Tibetan historians agree on this last point, and based on what we know of Indian Buddhist history it seems a likely place for historically significant Buddhist works to have been composed.) Paul Griffiths (1999, 114-24) uses the accounts of Chinese and Tibetan visitors to reconstruct a detailed account of what life and literary culture at Nālandā might have looked like.

Beyond these points, we can say relatively little beyond the approximate date of the texts’ composition. The Tibetan translator Ye shes sde, who rendered the BCA into Tibetan, worked under the king Khri lde srong brtsan (816-838 CE), so it must have been composed before that time (Bendall 1970, v). Since the Chinese pilgrim Yijing (or I-tsing) mentions all the major Indian Mahāyāna thinkers known in India but does not mention Śāntideva, it is likely that these texts were composed, or at least became famous, after Yijing left India in 685 CE (Pezzali 1968, 38). We may therefore assign Śāntideva an approximate date of  sometime in the eighth century.

c. Reception and Influence

As historical evidence on India is difficult to come by, it is relatively difficult to ascertain Śāntideva’s influence in the later Indian Buddhist philosophical tradition. Nevertheless, a significant number of later Indian texts do refer to the BCA and ŚS (Bendall 1970, viii-x), so Śāntideva’s work must have been relatively important there.

It is far easier to speak of Śāntideva’s influence in Tibet. Tibetan Buddhists revere Śāntideva and his work, especially the BCA. All the major Tibetan texts on the stages of the bodhisattva path, such as those of Tsong kha pa and sGam po pa, quote it at length (Sweet 1977, 4-5); it is a key  source for the entire Tibetan literary genre of blo sbyong or lojong (“mental purification”) (Sweet 1996, 245). The present Dalai Lama cites it as the highest inspiration for his ideals and practices (Williams 1995, ix). Tibetan commentators have written many commentaries on the text over the years, several of which are now available in English translation (e.g. Gyatso 1986; Rinpoche 2002; Tobden 2005). While the ŚS was less influential overall, the tradition has not ignored it. In 1998 the present Dalai Lama gave public teachings on the ŚS, referring to it as a “key which can unlock all the teachings of the Buddha” (quoted in Clayton 2006, 2). Śāntideva’s work has played a significant role in other cultures influenced by Tibetan Buddhism, such as Mongolia (see, for example, de Rachewiltz 1996; Kanaoka 1963). A less influential translation of the BCA was also made into Chinese (Bendall 1970, xxix-xxx).

The BCA has also been widely translated, studied, and admired in the West. (See Onishi 2003 for a thesis-length discussion of the text’s Western reception.) Luís Gómez (1999, 262-3) even suggests that it is now the third most frequently translated text in all of Indian Buddhism, after the Dhammapāda and the Heart Sūtra. A recent introductory text (Cooper 1998) also treats the BCA as one of “the classic readings” in ethics, alongside such works as Plato’s Gorgias and Mill’s Utilitarianism.  The BCA is an appropriate choice for a reading in Buddhist ethics, for relatively few Buddhist texts make explicit ethical arguments. This situation even leads one scholar (Keown 2005, 50) to proclaim that Buddhism “does not have normative ethics,” though he does not appear to have taken Śāntideva’s work into account in making this claim (see Lele 2007, 48-52).

2. The Progress of the Bodhisattva

The central concern of both of Śāntideva’s texts is the bodhisattva, literally “awakening-being.” A bodhisattva is a being aiming to become a buddha (literally “awakened one”); the process of the final transformation into a buddha is called bodhi, “awakening,” sometimes referred to as “enlightenment.” The title Bodhicaryâvatāra, “introduction to conduct for awakening,” is usually taken to be short for Bodhisattvacaryâvatāra — “introduction to the conduct of a bodhisattva,” or “A Guide to the Bodhisattva Way of Life,” as one major translation (Wallace and Wallace 1997) has it. “Introduction to the conduct of a bodhisattva” is an appropriate description of the contents of the text, although “introduction to conduct for awakening” would be equally appropriate. Śāntideva also introduces the Śikṣāsamuccaya by claiming he will explain the sugatâtmajasamvārâvatāra, a similar phrase meaning “introduction to the requirements for the sons of the Sugatas” (ŚS 1). (Throughout Buddhist literature sugata, literally “gone well,” is a common term for buddhas, and Mahāyāna literature regularly refers to bodhisattvas as the buddhas’ sons.) The term “bodhisattva” occurs at least seven times in the nineteen chapters of the ŚS. This section examines the bodhisattva’s progress from being an ordinary person through to being a buddha, as this progress is discussed in Śāntideva’s texts.

To describe those who are neither bodhisattvas nor buddhas, Śāntideva most frequently uses the term “ordinary person,” prithagjana. He refers at one point to “all buddhas, bodhisattvas, solitary buddhas, noble searchers and ordinary people” (ŚS 9) — suggesting that ordinary people are the residual category of all those who do not fall into the previous categories. It is standard in Mahāyāna texts to refer to three “vehicles” (yāna) or paths, with the vehicles of the searcher (śrāvaka) and solitary buddha (pratyekabuddha) being distinguished from the Great Vehicle (mahāyāna) of the bodhisattva. It is quite rare, however, for Śāntideva to refer to searchers and solitary buddhas, and even buddhas appear relatively infrequently, so in practice the most important distinction in his texts is between bodhisattvas and ordinary people.

Śāntideva’s view of ordinary people is not flattering. The term “ordinary person” frequently occurs in his work alongside the term “fool” (bāla) — sometimes with the latter as a modifier (“foolish ordinary person,” bālaprithagjana, as at ŚS 61) and sometimes with the two terms used synonymously and interchangeably, as at ŚS 194. Ordinary people’s foolishness traps them in suffering; the way for them to escape from suffering is to enter the bodhisattva path and become a bodhisattva.

To become a bodhisattva, one must possess the awakening mind (bodhicitta). This mental transformation brings one out of the status of ordinary person and points one toward awakening. Śāntideva makes an important distinction between two kinds of the awakening mind: the mind resolved on awakening (bodhipraṇidhicitta) and the mind proceeding to awakening (bodhiprasthānacitta). The first, he tells us, can be reached quickly; it exists when the thought “I must become a buddha” arises as a vow (ŚS 8). He is not as explicit about the nature of the second, but in describing the first he notes that “the awakening mind is productive even without conduct” (ŚS 9), suggesting that conduct (caryā, bodhicaryā) may be what makes the difference between the mind resolved on awakening and the mind proceeding to awakening. (Brassard 2000 is a book-length study of the awakening mind and the BCA.)

It would appear, however, that possession of the mind resolved on awakening     is sufficient to make its possessor into a bodhisattva. The BCA, recall, suggests that it is intended to be ritually recited. Its reader develops the awakening mind while reciting the third chapter sincerely — saying “Therefore I will produce the awakening mind for the welfare of the world” (BCA III.23). Two verses later, the reciter, apparently not having done anything else in the intervening time, declares: “Today I have been born into the family of the buddhas; now I am a child of the buddhas,” which is to say a bodhisattva(BCA III.25).

This is not, of course, the end of the story. Such a beginning bodhisattva has just started on the path; he has a long task ahead of him. Śāntideva does not spell out the different levels of attainment that a bodhisattva may reach, but he suggests that he agrees with the account of ten stages (bhūmi) of a bodhisattva’s achievement, as set out in the Daśabhūmika Sūtra and followed in Candrakīrti’s Madhyamakâvatāra (see Sprung 1979 for a partial translation of, and commentary on, this latter text). The ŚS quotes the Daśabhūmika six times. In this context, Śāntideva distinguishes between “one who has entered a stage” (bhūmipraviṣṭa) and a beginning (ādikarmika) bodhisattva (ŚS 11), suggesting that beginning bodhisattvas have not even entered the first of the ten stages.

Notice, however, that the BCA’s reciter does not become a bodhisattva, even a beginning one, until taking the vow in the third chapter. So Śāntideva’s audience, it would seem, is not limited to bodhisattvas — a point strengthened by the profuse praises of the awakening mind in the opening chapters of both texts. The reader who starts the text might not have generated the awakening mind, hence not have started trying to become a bodhisattva, and needs to be convinced of the importance of doing so.

The eighteenth chapter of the ŚS gives some account of the end of the path. It gives a fantastical description of the buddhas — their great beauty, virtue and power (ŚS 318-22). Shortly afterwards, it also describes the qualities of bodhisattvas in similar terms  and at greater length. It is difficult to imagine how a reader who had just become a bodhisattva, taking the vow, could see himself as described by these qualities — spontaneously emitting perfumes and garlands and pearls from his body, for example (ŚS 327) — so this is likely the culmination of a long period of effort, in the last stages of which one becomes a fully realized bodhisattva. The distinctions between buddhas and fully realized bodhisattvas are not clearly spelled out; one suspects that being one of these advanced bodhisattvas is almost as good as being an actual buddha.

3. Excellence in Means

To interpret Śāntideva’s ethics in the BCA and ŚS, it is important to turn to the concept of excellence in means (upāyakauśalya). This common Mahāyāna concept is best known as a way of explaining the existence of other Buddhist traditions, as in texts like the Lotus Sūtra: the Buddha preached mainstream Buddhism as a clever way to reach people who were not ready to receive the superior teaching of the Mahāyāna. (See Pye 1978 for a book-length discussion.)

The term has a number of different senses in Buddhist tradition (see Harvey 2000, 134-40). Some Mahāyāna texts treat excellence in means as the seventh of ten perfections or virtues (pāramitā); Śāntideva does not do this, as he adheres to the conception that there are only six perfections (on which see below). For him, there are two senses in which the idea is important. The first is hermeneutical: different teachings are intended for people at different levels of ability, with the idea of ultimate truth at the very highest level (see BCA IX.2-8). For this reason the BCA is usually understood as a progressive text, leading its audience through progressively deeper levels of practice and understanding (e.g. see Crosby and Skilton 1995, 83-6). Śāntideva does not specifically use the term “excellence in means” to refer to this idea, although it is a common name for the idea in other Mahāyāna texts (Harvey 2000, 134). The second sense of the term is ethical; the idea most frequently comes up when he quotes the Upāyakauśalya Sūtra, a text which claims that bodhisattvas may break standard precepts or rules out of compassion. (The sūtra exists in Chinese and has been translated into English twice: Chang 1991, 427-68, and Tatz 1994.)

This second sense of excellence in means takes on considerable importance in contemporary discussions of Śāntideva’s ethics (e.g. Clayton 2006, 102-9) because it is under this rubric that Śāntideva comes closest to addressing the “hard cases” so beloved of contemporary moral philosophy, such as situations when one seems called on to kill in order to prevent a greater evil. While discussing excellence in means, he explains that behaviors normally forbidden, including sexual activity, can be permitted out of compassion. So too, it is to explain the importance of excellence in means that Śāntideva notes that one is permitted to kill someone about to commit a grave wrong. The idea is important to this article for similar reasons, in that it seems to be a key principle involved in what we might call Śāntideva’s casuistry — his examination of particular cases where different pieces of advice seem to collide.

For Śāntideva, a key component of excellence in means is that it is an excellence — a skill and a virtue which allows one to respond appropriately to difficult situations, if not a virtue on the official list of six perfections. There is no one formula or principle for action that Śāntideva sets out in advance (along the lines of “act to bring about the greatest happiness for the greatest number” or “act only according to that maxim you can also will to be a universal law”). As we will shortly see, there are definite elements of consequentialist reasoning in Śāntideva, but more often the bodhisattva is called on to exercise judgment, once his character is already well developed: When Śāntideva says that “even the forbidden is permitted,” it is specifically “for a compassionate one who has sight of the purpose” (BCA V.84); that is, it depends on the agent’s ability to exercise discretion in the name of compassion.

This level of discretion is evinced in the numerous places in Śāntideva’s work where difficult cases are considered. When he approves of the killing of someone about to commit a grave wrong, he says only that there is “permission” (anujñāna), not that it must be done. Similarly, in the case of alcoholics, alcohol may be given; Śāntideva uses the gerundive form deya (ŚS 271), and the gerundive in -ya does not have the imperative force of the gerundive in -tavya.

Śāntideva explicitly refers to consequences in the case of giving a weapon: one may do so after the “consideration of good or bad consequences” (ŚS 271). This is still a consideration or reflection rather than a maximizing or weighing; “consideration,” vicāra, is literally “moving around (in the mind).” A weighing of some sort comes across in introducing the possibility that one might have sex out of compassion: “even then, if one should see a greater benefit (artha) to beings, one may discard the training” (ŚS 167). Some sort of consequentialist maximizing appears to be at work here. Clayton (2006, 107) suggests that such concern for consequences means that these “examples of upāya become problematic from the perspective of a virtue ethic.” However, for Śāntideva, any true “benefit” to other beings will ultimately be an increase in their virtue. Goodman (2008) argues strongly for a consequentialist interpretation of Śāntideva’s ethics, but on the understanding that it is a “perfectionist consequentialism,” in which the consequences to be maximized consist of virtue in oneself and others.

4. Good and Bad Karma

The terms “good karma” and “bad karma,” respectively, translate the Sanskrit terms puṇya and pāpa. These terms appear very frequently in Śāntideva’s work — often as justifications for acting and feeling in a certain way. They refer to a kind of ethical causality: the process by which ethically good and bad actions (respectively) have positive and negative results. These results most characteristically, but not exclusively, include better and worse rebirths. The Sanskrit terms parallel the English usage of “good and bad karma,” thought of as the way in which one’s good or bad actions come back to affect one positively or negatively in the future. This usage corresponds exactly to the meaning of the Buddhist terms puṇya and pāpa, even though those terms do not themselves involve the Sanskrit word karma or karman (which simply means “action”). There is, at any rate, no disputing the close connection between Sanskrit karma, on the one hand, and puṇya and pāpa on the other; the latter are typically referred to in Sanskrit as karmaphala, the fruits of action.

The concepts of good and bad karma are central to Śāntideva’s thought. The ŚS is typically thought to be structured around the idea, presented inŚSK 4, that one should “protect, purify and enhance” one’s person, one’s possessions and one’s good karma, though one should also be prepared to give all of these things away (Bendall 1970, xi). ŚS 356 connects each of these verbs to good and bad karma: to “protect” something is to prevent new karmically bad mental states (dharmas) related to it; to “purify” it is to reduce the existing karmically bad states related to it; and to “enhance” it is to increase the karmically good states related to it. (Mahoney 2002, 32-9 identifies the significance of these verbs with respect to the traditional Buddhist samyakprahānas or “right strivings”.) In a certain sense, one might see the ŚS as being all about good and bad karma — a sense strengthened by the long discussions of bad karma in ŚS III, IV and VIII, and of the good karma deriving from worship in ŚS XVII. In the BCA, too, the final chapter — the highest and most important, if one adheres strictly to a progressive understanding of the text — deals with the redirection (pariṇāmanā) of good karma. Dayal (1970, 189-90) goes so far as to say that Śāntideva substituted karmic redirection for metaphysical insight as the ultimate goal of the bodhisattva path. Clayton (2006, 83) and Lele (2007, 96-7) argue that Dayal’s claim is overstated, but neither dispute that good and bad karma are vitally important to Śāntideva’s work. Clayton (2006, 67) identifies three terms closely related to good karma (kuśala, śīla and puṇya) as the most central ethical concepts in the ŚS, and even as “probably the most important ethical concepts in Indian Buddhism” more generally.

The redirection of good karma (often called “transference of merit”) is a central part of Śāntideva’s understanding of karma’s workings. He urges his readers to redirect any good karma that they acquire, so that it does not merely result in a worldly form of well-being, such as a more prosperous rebirth for oneself. This redirection can sometimes be to ensure that the good karma brings one closer to awakening instead of worldly rebirths (bodhipariṇāmanā, ŚS 158); see Kajiyama 1989 for a discussion of this first form, which is often neglected in studies of karmic redirection. More frequently, though, it means the giving up of one’s good karma to others (puṇyotsarga). This is a common idea in Buddhist texts. Buddhist stories often emphasize the supernatural nature of karmic redirection. Especially, they commonly claim or imply that ghosts (pretas or petas) are incapable of receiving physical gifts. If one wishes to give them something, it must be one’s good karma(Kajiyama 1989, 7-8).

In contemporary philosophical terms, Śāntideva’s idea of karma suggests, though not conclusively, an internal connection between virtue or ethical excellence and well-being. That is, he often uses these terms in a way that suggests that virtue is well-being in many significant senses. He does this by using puṇya in ways that make it equivalent both to virtue or excellence and to well-being or flourishing. Śāntideva uses the term for good karma (puṇya) interchangeably with the terms for good conduct (śīla) and excellence (kuśala) (see Lele 2007, 79-82)(Clayton 2006, 73). Even more frequently, however, he equates it with well-being or welfare, śubha, as Clayton (2006, 48-51) notes. This equivalence suggests a sense in which, on Śāntideva’s understanding, good karma not only produces well-being, but is well-being — constitutive of a good life, at least at the level of conventional truth. There does remain some ambiguity, however, in the sense that Śāntideva’s work also suggests that well-being is the product of the result or “ripening” (vipāka) of good karma.

This ambiguity may be compared to that in Greek conceptions of eudaimonia, which also means human welfare or flourishing, but includes a strong element of excellence (aretē) as well. To the extent that good karma is equated with excellence, Śāntideva’s thought resembles that of the Stoics, who thought that excellence alone constituted well-being. To the extent that good karma is equated with the results of excellent action, however, it looks more like Aristotle’s view, where “external goods,” outside the control of the agent’s excellence or lack thereof, are intrinsic components of well-being. (See Greek Philosophy and Stoicism.) However, Śāntideva does not ever suggest, as Aristotle does, that everyone aims at well-being but not everyone knows what it is (NE 1095a).

However we interpret the relation between action and result, it would seem that for Śāntideva good karma, as a complex of virtue and well-being, effectively constitutes its own intrinsic reason for action, as eudaimonia does. That a given action or mental state is karmically good, and that it is good per se, seem to be one and the same; Śāntideva does not make claims of the form “one should refrain from an action or mental state in spite of the good karma it generates,” or “one should have an action or mental state even though it is karmically bad.” Amod Lele argues that “there are a number of cases where it would seem like Śāntideva is saying it is not good to have more good karma, but in nearly all such cases, he actually ends up saying that the apparent loss of good karma turns out to bring more good karma” (Lele 2007, 85-7, emphasis in original).

5. The Perfections

Śāntideva typically describes the bodhisattva in terms of his six “perfections” (pāramitās); e.g., ŚS 97, 187. The perfections are beneficial and valuable traits of character, similar to Aristotelian virtues or excellences. This article renders Śāntideva’s term pāramitā as the literal “perfection” rather than as “virtue” because Śāntideva does discuss other virtues — beneficial traits of character — which are not themselves considered pāramitās, such as nonattachment and esteem.

The six perfections are nearly always arranged in ascending order: giving or generosity (dāna), good conduct (śīla), patient endurance (kṣānti), heroic strength (vīrya), meditation (dhyāna) and metaphysical insight (prajñā). An observer might be tempted to apply Aristotle’s classification  of the virtues  here and identify the first four as “moral” virtues, the sixth (and possibly the fifth) as “intellectual.” However, one should bear in mind the significance of Aristotle’s distinction: intellectual virtues are primarily attained through teaching, moral virtues through habituation (NE 1103a). Śāntideva does not distinguish the perfections in this regard; as we will see in the section on metaphysical insight below, in many ways it too is acquired through habituation.

The perfections are sufficiently important to Śāntideva’s ethical thought that  both of his texts are to some extent structured around them. The final four perfections are explicitly identified, in turn, as the topics of the BCA’s chapters VI through IX. Patient endurance and heroic strength are also identified as the topics of ŚS chapters IX and X. While the first two perfections — giving or generosity (dāna) and good conduct (śīla) — do not receive their own chapter headings, they do have an important place in Śāntideva’s ethical worldview, as we will see.

a. Giving

Śāntideva uses the term dāna to refer both to the act of giving, and to the perfection which might more idiomatically be rendered into English as generosity (dānapāramitā). He does not usually distinguish between the two. This article follows his usage and uses “giving” and “generosity” as synonyms.

Giving has relatively little role in the BCA except for its role in the redirection of good karma, mentioned above. In the ŚS, however, it takes pride of place. The first chapter of the ŚS closes by claiming that “giving alone is the bodhisattva’s awakening” (ŚS 34).  Richard Mahoney (2002), undertaking a detailed study of the ŚS’s structure, has demonstrated that the entire text is effectively organized around the idea of protecting, purifying and enhancing one’s person, possessions and good karma — culminating in giving each of these three things away.

Why is giving so important to Śāntideva? For him, giving serves at least three important and distinct purposes: first, the development of nonattachment; second, the “upward” expression of esteem (śraddhā); and third, “downward” compassionate benefit to others. Each of these three, for him, is an essential component of the bodhisattva path, and giving allows one to realize each component, though in different ways.

i. Giving as Giving Up

The first reason Śāntideva offers for giving is that one should not be attached to things in the first place; one should be ready to give them away. Śāntideva sometimes uses terms, utsarga and tyāga, which have both the sense of “giving” and of “renunciation.” By giving something to another person, one both demonstrates one’s own lack of attachment to it and minimizes the risk that it will cause future attachment. As a result, one generates a great deal of good karma. Here giving is primarily “giving up”; “giving to” is a secondary function. Śāntideva expresses this rationale for giving most forcefully in a long passage excerpted here:

What is given must no longer be guarded; what is at home must be guarded. What is given is [the cause] for the reduction of craving (triṣṇā); what is at home is the increase of craving. What is given is nonattachment (aparigraha); what is at home is with attachment (saparigraha). What is given is safe; what is at home is dangerous. What is given is [the cause] for supporting the path of awakening; what is at home is [the cause] for supporting Māra [the demonic tempter]. What is given is imperishable; what is at home is perishable. From what is given [comes] happiness; having obtained what is at home, [there is] suffering. (ŚS 19)

This passage indicates a common theme in Śāntideva’s work, one more radical than some other Buddhist takes on attachment and possession. It is not merely that a bodhisattva should avoid attachment to possessions, but that the possessions are themselves potentially harmful, because having them creates a danger of increasing one’s attachment to them. Thus Śāntideva claims elsewhere that a bodhisattva “should have fear of material gain (lābha) and of honour,” (ŚSK 16) and that “great gain is among the obstacles to the Mahāyāna” (ŚS 145).

ii. Upward Gifts: Expressing Esteem

The second reason for giving is to express one’s esteem or trust (śraddhā) in beings who have achieved a higher level on the bodhisattva path. The term śraddhā has a number of different and related senses, usually blending together: esteem, trust, confidence, devotion, faith. Maria Hibbets’s (2000) rendering “esteem” may come closest overall to the sense in which Śāntideva uses the term, though it loses the important connotation of trust. Śraddhā, Śāntideva says, is the prasāda (peaceful pleasure) of an unsoiled mind, rooted in respect (gaurava, literally “weightiness,” like the Latin gravitas), without arrogance (ŚS 5). Those without esteem oppose or ridicule buddhas (ŚS 174). One with esteem will listen whenever the Buddha’s word is spoken (ŚS 15); esteem is that by which one approaches the noble ones (Buddhas) and does not do what should not be done (ŚS 316).

When a householder makes a gift to a monk, especially a gift of food, it is called a śraddhādeya, a gift by esteem (ŚS 137-8). Similarly, when the aspiring bodhisattva makes offerings to advanced bodhisattvas and buddhas as part of the seven-part Anuttarapūjā ritual worship in BCA II.10-19, the act expresses esteem. Śāntideva does not use the word śraddhā in this passage, but the feelings it evokes match his descriptions of esteem elsewhere: a pleasurable trust in more advanced beings, recognizing their status as more advanced, that leads to better actions. Just before describing the fabulous offerings he gives, Śāntideva’s narrator describes the esteem he places in the buddhas and bodhisattvas and the good action that will result from doing so:

by becoming your possession, I am in a state of fearlessness; I make the well-being of all beings. I overcome previous bad karma and will make no further bad karma. (BCA II.9)

This esteem has deeply important benefits. It is a pleasure taken in good actions; it is “a maker of gladness about renunciation, a maker of excitement about the Jinas’ (Buddhas’) dharma” (ŚS 3). This combination of trust and pleasure leads one on to good action; as Śāntideva says, those who always have esteem toward a respectable Buddha will abandon neither good conduct nor training (ŚS 3). So the practice of esteem helps increase one’s good karma (ŚS 317).  Moreover, to encourage the growth of esteem in a giver, when an aspiring bodhisattva receives a gift, he encourages the giver and makes him feel excited about giving it (ŚS 150).

iii. Downward Gifts: Attracting Others

When one gives for either of the above reasons (expressing nonattachment or expressing esteem), one effectively does so for one’s own spiritual benefit. But Śāntideva also says that one gives to all beings (sarvasatvebhyas, ŚSK 4), for their enjoyment (ŚSK 5), adding that one also preserves the gift for the sake of their enjoyment (satvôpabhogārtham, ŚSK 6). Here he is advocating a different kind of giving, motivated by compassion and aimed at benefitting the recipient. The distinction between the second two types of giving corresponds to Maria Heim’s (Heim 2004, 74-5) distinction between “upward” and “downward” giving, out of esteem and out of compassion.

The reasons Śāntideva offers for downward giving are not as straightforward as they may first appear. For Śāntideva, the recipient of a gift benefits less from possessing the gift object, and more from receiving it in a gift encounter. When a bodhisattva gives a gift, he attracts the recipient to the bodhisattva path, so that the recipient is more likely to become a virtuous bodhisattva. The gift object itself provides little benefit, and could even be harmful (2007, 136-75).

As well as giving possessions and more conventional goods, one also gives good karma to others through its redirection (parināmanā), as noted above. Since Śāntideva tends to see good karma as intrinsically good, in this case the recipient is more likely to benefit from the gift itself. Even so, good karma involves a potential danger, since if it is not redirected it can lead merely to dangerous wealth rather than to awakening.

b. Good Conduct

Of all the perfections, Śāntideva tells us the least about the second one, śīla. This Sanskrit and Pali term has a general sense of “good conduct” or “good habits,” but its particular meaning is less clear. Unlike the final four perfections, it is not identified specifically as the single topic of a chapter in the BCA, and the chapters identified with it in the ŚS (II and V) make little reference to it. Unlike giving, it is not discussed at systematic length in either text. Śāntideva sometimes uses the term in a broad sense that would seem to encompass all of the perfections, to the point of using it interchangeably with puṇya, good karma, or śubha, well-being (Clayton 2006, 73). ŚS chapter V, entitled Śīlapāramitāyām Anarthavarjanam — abandoning of the worthless with respect to the perfection of good conduct — seems like a miscellany of topics, describing a wide variety of actions that Śāntideva endorses. A reader may then be tempted to take up the common usage in which this good conduct refers to “morality,” “virtue” or “ethics” in a general sense (see Clayton 2006, 72-3) — perhaps even a sense that includes the other perfections.

Yet Śāntideva does give some further specification of a way in which he understands “good conduct,” conceptually distinct from the other perfections, even though he does not stick consistently to this usage. His one reference to the perfection of good conduct in the BCA proclaims: “when the mind of cessation (viraticitta) is obtained, the perfection of good conduct is understood [to exist]” (BCAP 53). The ŚS specifies the goal of good conduct in a similar vein, but is more specific about what constitutes good conduct: “whichever practices are causes of meditative concentration (samādhi), those are included in good conduct” (ŚS 121). It seems that good conduct, when understood as a single perfection, consists primarily of practices that aid one to concentrate one’s mind and still its uncontrolled activity.

This suggestion is borne out by the content of the fifth BCA chapter, which, following up the claim about the mind of cessation, details exactly these sorts of practices. (Since this chapter comes immediately before the chapter on patient endurance — the third perfection — it would be a logical place for Śāntideva to discuss good conduct, the second perfection.) The chapter begins by warning the reader of the dangers of an unrestrained mind, comparing it to a mad, rutting elephant, and then specifies a number of practices that Śāntideva claims will help the mind remain under control.  We may imagine, then, that this chapter gives us some idea of what Śāntideva means by the perfection of good conduct.

The practices bear some resemblance to Buddhist monastic rules (vinaya), although they could all be followed by lay householders and the text does not restrict them to monks. Śāntideva urges his readers to walk with a downcast gaze, as if continually meditating, but notes that they may look outward to rest their eyes or to greet someone. One should look ahead (or behind) before moving there, he says, and think about one’s actions before undertaking them; one should continually observe the positioning of one’s body. Each of these actions, Śāntideva specifies, allows one to restrain the mind (BCA V.35-40). Similarly, one should avoid idle chatter, or purposeless nervous tics (BCA V.45-6). In general, as Susanne Mrozik notes, “Close careful attention to one’s bodily movements and gestures generates mindfulness and awareness. Disciplining the body is thus a means of disciplining one’s thoughts and feelings” (Mrozik 1998, 63).

Śāntideva notes that the relationship between good conduct and meditative concentration is two-way: “One aiming at meditative concentration should have good conduct, for mindfulness and introspection; so too, one aiming at good conduct should make effort at meditative concentration.” He claims that the “complete perfection of mental action” will comes from the two “mutually enhancing causes” that are good conduct and meditative concentration (ŚS 121).

The second half of the fifth BCA chapter involves details about bodily comportment which aim at pleasing others, rather than at focusing the mind; similar instructions are found in the sixth chapter of the ŚS. It is possible, though not clear, that Śāntideva also intends these to be included under good conduct. Śāntideva here enjoins etiquette of various kinds (do not spit in public, do not make noises while eating) and a pleasant tone of speaking (BCA V.71-96, ŚS 124-7). Mrozik (2007, 75-6) notes that such actions are intended to generate prasāda, a kind of peaceful pleasure, in those who observe the bodhisattva. Lele (2007, 151-9) suggests further that the goal of generating this prasāda is to attract them to the bodhisattva path, making them more likely to enter that path and increase their well-being.

c. Patient Endurance

Śāntideva divides patient endurance (kṣānti) into three major varieties: first, enduring suffering (duṣkhâdhivāsanakṣānti); second, dharmic patience, the patient endurance that comes from reflecting on the Buddha’s teaching, the dharma (dharmanidhyānakṣānti); and third, patience toward others’ wrongdoing (parâpakāramarṣanakṣānti, ŚS 179). The first, which Śāntideva opposes to frustration (daurmanasya), is closer to the English word “endurance”; the third, which Śāntideva opposes to anger (dveṣa), is closer to the English word “patience.” For this reason it is helpful to use a two-word term like “patient endurance” to encapsulate the idea of kṣānti as a whole. Śāntideva does not link these phenomena under the rubric of patient endurance merely for the sake of convenience or etymology; rather, patient endurance has common elements that pervade them all. In all three cases, one remains calm and even happy in the face of various undesired events — pains, frustrations, wrongs — that one might face.

Dharmic patience, the second variety — as Śāntideva describes it in BCA VI.22-32 — is juxtaposed against anger, and involves being patient with others’ bad actions. For this reason, it seems largely like a subtype of the third type, patience toward wrongdoing, which involves reflecting on the fact that their actions all have causes. Śāntideva likely treats the two as distinct in order to emphasize the particular importance of metaphysical reasons for patient endurance. In terms of the actions and mental dispositions that they entail, they do not appear to be different from each other. So we may here subsume this second variety under the third, except as otherwise specified.

There are at least two ways in which enduring suffering and patience toward wrongdoing are closely related in Śāntideva’s work. First, there is a logical or analytical relationship. When one is wronged by others, it is likely to be an undesired event, and therefore experienced as suffering. So, effectively, the events that evoke patience toward wrongdoing are a subset of those that evoke the endurance of  suffering. The appropriate reactions are intertwined as well. We see this when Śāntideva discusses being the victim of theft. While he addresses theft in the context of anger, and more generally of patience toward wrongdoing, the reason he gives to remain patient is that possessions are dangerous to have anyway (BCA VI.100) — a central part of Śāntideva’s justifications for nonattachment, which itself is very closely tied to enduring suffering.

Second, there is a causal relationship. Enduring suffering, as Śāntideva discusses it, requires that one fight frustration; patience toward wrongdoing requires that one fight anger. And both of Śāntideva’s texts (ŚS 179 and BCA VI.7-8) note that anger feeds on frustration; so enduring suffering makes it easier to have patience toward wrongdoing.

i. Happiness from Enduring Suffering

Śāntideva’s case for enduring suffering is relatively straightforward: one will feel less suffering and be happier. Early in his discussion of frustration (daurmanasya), Śāntideva makes the pragmatic point that it accomplishes little. So it is not only an unpleasant mental state, but an unnecessary one: “If indeed there is a remedy, then what’s the point of frustration? And if there is no remedy, then what’s the point of frustration?” (BCA VI.10).

Enduring suffering can lead to happiness, for Śāntideva, in a particularly extreme meditative state (samādhi). He refers to this state as the sarvadharmasukhakrānta, “making happiness toward all phenomena.” The passage describing this meditative state is one of the most provocative in the entire ŚS. Śāntideva says that “for a bodhisattva who has obtained this meditative state, with respect to all sense objects, pain is felt as happiness indeed, not as suffering or as indifference” (ŚS 181). He proceeds to describe a panoply of graphic tortures in a startlingly upbeat manner. For example:

[The bodhisattva who has attained this meditative state], while being fried in oil, or while pounded like pounded sugarcane, or while crushed like a reed, or while being burned in the way that oil or ghee or yogurt are burned — has a happy thought arisen. (ŚS 181)

While a reader might cringe at the literal masochism in this passage, it is also not hard to see the power of its appeal: It strongly suggests that a bodhisattva can be happy anywhere, any time, in any condition. And there is a particular practice that the bodhisattva pursues to reach this state. Whenever he is subjected to such an unpleasant fate, he makes a mental determination or vow (pranidhāna) that everyone, from those who honor him to those who torture him, should reach the great awakening (ŚS 182). In the BCA he suggests starting with small pains to learn to endure bigger ones: “because of the practice of mild distress, even great distress is tolerable” (BCA VI.14). Prajñākaramati draws a direct connection between the two, quoting the ŚS passage in his commentary on the BCA verse.

ii. The Case Against Anger

Śāntideva’s arguments for patience toward wrongdoing consist of arguments against anger, against which this patience is juxtaposed. He lays out these arguments primarily in the sixth chapter of the BCA; for a detailed commentary on this chapter, see Thurman 2004. His arguments here derive from premises both naturalistic and supernaturalistic: “One who destroys anger is happy in this world and the next” (BCA VI.6).

Śāntideva’s naturalistic arguments against anger rest first on psychological grounds: “The mind does not get peace, nor enjoy pleasure and happiness, nor find sleep or satisfaction, when the dart of anger rests in the heart” (BCA VI.3). This set of psychological claims has a strong intuitive plausibility, in our context as well as his; it is probably not difficult for anyone to remember times that anger has negatively affected her peace of mind or pleasure or sleep.

Beyond this, Śāntideva seeks to minimize the significance of others’ wrongdoing (apakāra). He is especially concerned to neutralize insults and the destruction of praise. He asks: “The gang of contempt, harsh speech and infamy does not bind my body. Why, O mind, do you get enraged by it?” (BCA VI.53)

Śāntideva also offers severe warnings concerning the karmic consequences of anger. There is no bad karma equal to anger, he says, so patient endurance is the most effective means to reduce bad karma (BCA VI.2). He warns that anger leads to suffering in the hell realms far greater than the suffering that originally provoked the anger:

If suffering merely here and now cannot be endured, why is anger, the cause of distress in hell, not restrained? In the same way, for the sake of anger I have been placed in hells thousands of times; I have done this neither for my own sake nor for anyone else’s. (BCA VI.73-4)

There is only one kind of anger that Śāntideva seems to approve of, effectively an exception that proves the rule. He approves of anger when it is directed at anger itself: “Let anger toward anger be my choice” (BCA VI.41). More generally, he suggests elsewhere that anger at “my enemies, craving, anger and so on” (BCA IV.28) might be valuable: “Lodged in my own mind, these well-stood ones still harm me. In this very case I do not get angry. Damn, what unsuitable patience (sahiṣṇutā)!” (BCA IV.29).

Śāntideva also makes the case for dharmic patience (dharmanidhyānakṣānti) in BCA VI.22-32; this, as mentioned earlier, is patience toward wrongdoing which is informed by metaphysical insight. Śāntideva’s point here is that the emotion of anger comes out of an incorrect belief about the world — namely that other agents can appropriately be blamed for their actions. “I have no anger at my bile and so on, though they make great suffering. Why is there anger at sentient beings? They too are angry due to a cause” (BCA VI.22). Anger, whether my own or another’s, has its causes. It is not chosen; it is merely another product of the universe’s dependent arising (BCA VI.23-26). Moreover, there is no self which is capable of being an agent of anger (BCA VI.27-30). And “therefore, whether one has seen an enemy or a friend doing something wrong, having considered that the act has causes, one should become happy” (BCA VI.33). Mark Siderits (2005) refers to this argument for dharmic patience as “paleo-compatibilist,” and suggests that it can help resolve contemporary debates on free will and determinism.

These arguments against anger are phrased in terms that could convince someone not already on the path. Other arguments are directed specifically at bodhisattvas. As has been mentioned before, it is crucial for the bodhisattva to win beings over; and anger interferes with this activity, where desire (rāga) might be able on some occasions to help with it. This is why anger, in Śāntideva’s eyes, is far worse than desire, though desire and anger are both afflictions (kleṣas) that cloud the mind and lead one on to suffering (ŚS 164).

He claims further that “bodhisattvas who are not excellent in means (upāyakuśala) fear downfalls connected with desire (rāga); bodhisattvas who are excellent in means fear downfalls connected with anger, not downfalls connected with desire” (ŚS 164-5). Excellence in means (upāyakauśalya), the ability to teach others in the appropriate way to bring them onto the path, is deeply hindered by anger. Unlike desire, anger has no saving graces. Anger both creates suffering for oneself and interferes with one’s ability to benefit others; this is why nothing is as karmically bad as anger, or as karmically good as patient endurance.

d. Heroic Strength

Śāntideva devotes relatively little attention to the fourth perfection, heroic strength (vīrya). Each of his texts has a short chapter (BCA VII and ŚS X) devoted to it; parallel discussions occur in the fourth chapter of the BCA. He defines heroic strength as “excellent effort” (kuśalotsaha, BCA VII.2), effort that is both skillful and virtuous — a tireless striving on the bodhisattva path. In BCA VII, he contrasts heroic strength with laziness (ālasya, BCA VII.3). The primary point of BCA VII is to insist on the urgency of the bodhisattva’s task. It is rare to be born as a human, and a short human life leaves one with little time for adequate spiritual development, so it is crucial to devote oneself wholeheartedly to the task.

ŚS X, the shortest chapter in the text — a mere four pages — explains the importance of listening to sacred texts (śruta). The topic is surprising, since it seems tangentially related, at best, to the more straightforward heroic strength addressed in BCA VII. The connection seems to be that, to listen to sacred texts properly, one must do so tirelessly. If one does not do so, Śāntideva claims, even a sacred text can lead to  “destruction” (vināśa), probably because one reads and applies the text too selectively (ŚS 189).

e. Meditation

The fifth perfection, discussed in BCA VIII and ŚS XI-XIII, is meditation (dhyāna). Meditation for Śāntideva is very much an intellectual and even philosophical exercise, not merely a stilling of the mind; some of Śāntideva’s most famous arguments appear in a context of discussions of meditation. Śāntideva emphasizes that a calming and stilling of the mind is essential to meditation, and enjoins his reader to flee society and find a solitary spot in the wilderness in order to achieve the proper degree of undistracted calm (BCA VIII.1-40, ŚS 193-201). But becoming calm and solitary, in both texts, is only the first step to grasping arguments and transformative techniques with an explicit cognitive content.

In the BCA, the first meditation that Śāntideva describes sharpens his emphasis on solitude: one considers the foulness of the human body. Specifically, his male audience is urged to reflect on the foulness of a potential female lover. He notes that the beloved will invariably become a corpse, highlights the repulsiveness of corpses, and asks the reader rhetorically why the living beloved seems any less repulsive (VIII.41-7). He then calls attention to the repulsiveness of the body’s waste products, natural smells, and fluids (VIII.48-71). Next he notes the great effort one must take in finding and keeping a lover, and the ultimate vanity of such efforts (VIII.72-83).

This meditation takes on a strongly misogynist tone, describing as it does the repulsiveness of female bodies. A contemporary reader should keep in mind its intent as a critique of lust, the passion which so easily distracts the mind from the bodhisattva’s path. While the argument is phrased in terms of the foulness of a woman’s body, its logic would apply equally well to the foulness of a man’s body, if imagined by a heterosexual female or homosexual male meditator. (Śāntideva never inverts the argument this way himself. As Wilson 1996 notes, historically Buddhists have never turned the arguments about female foulness around to have it apply to men, even when speaking to a female audience. The point is noted here to stress the relevance of these meditations for a contemporary philosophical audience, rightly skeptical of misogynistic claims.) The ideal to achieve in this lifetime, for Śāntideva, is that of a male or female monk who forswears lust and sexuality, and he calls attention to the body’s repulsive aspects in order to convince his readers of this ideal’s value.

i. Equalization of Self and Other

The two meditations which follow in BCA VIII, on the relationship between oneself and another, are Śāntideva’s most famous. The first of these is known as the equalization of self and other (parātmasamatā). In this meditation Śāntideva argues for an ethical conclusion from a metaphysical premise: because the self is empty and unreal, it makes little sense to protect only oneself from suffering and not others.

The arguments are framed against a hypothetical objector (pūrvapakṣin) who wishes to prevent only his own suffering, but not that of others. Suffering here has a strong normative force; that suffering is bad and worthy of prevention is taken as self-evident, and Śāntideva assumes that his readers will share that assumption. When an imagined objector asks why suffering should be prevented at all, he responds, “No one disputes that!” (BCA VIII.103) If we substitute “the absence of suffering” for “pleasure,” Śāntideva’s claim here seems to work like Alasdair MacIntyre’s interpretation of Mill’s claim that we know pleasure is desirable because men desire it:

He treats the thesis that all men desire pleasure as a factual assertion which guarantees the success of an ad hominem apeal to anyone who denies his conclusion. If anyone denies that pleasure is desirable, then we can ask him, But don’t you desire it? and we know in advance that he must answer yes, and consequently must admit that pleasure is desirable. (MacIntyre 1966, 239)

To deny that suffering should be prevented at all, in other words, is to argue in bad faith: anyone who makes such a claim does not really believe it. It is not hard to see the intuitive force of Śāntideva’s claim about suffering; while one might come up with exceptions, in general most human beings in most contexts have viewed suffering as something bad and undesirable.

The selfish objector is right, then, to believe that suffering should be prevented. Where he goes awry is in focusing only on his own suffering; this focus turns out to be absurd. There is no self that endures from moment to moment, so one’s own future self is as different from one’s present self as other beings are: “If [someone else] is not protected because his suffering cannot hurt me — the sufferings of a future body are not mine. Why is that hurt protected against?” (BCA VIII.97) Śāntideva’s arguments here have been compared to those of Derek Parfit (1984), who also attacks the metaphysical premise of selfhood as a premise for an altruistic ethics.

Paul Williams (1998a, 30) notes that most commentators, including Prajñākaramati, have read this verse so that the “future body” (āgāmikāya) means only the bodies one will inhabit in future rebirths, not the future state of one’s body in the present life. A literal reading of this verse and the next would suggest that they are right; the next verse adds that “one is dead, a very different other one is born” (BCA VIII.98). So Williams thinks that “from a textual point of view” this verse must be correct. However, later Tibetan commentators, especially rGyal tshab rje, interpret the verse so that it could refer to any present suffering one might try to prevent (Williams 1998a, 32-6). The “death” and “birth” would likely then refer to the body’s non-enduring nature — dying as the present moment passes away and being born anew in the following moment — rather than to literal death and rebirth. Logically this seems a more satisfying reading. The argument seems entirely superfluous if it refers only to future births; based on everything else that Śāntideva says, one concerned with better future births should, above all, prevent the suffering of others.

Śāntideva makes an additional argument beyond the point about future selves. Even the present self should be broken up into its parts. When the opponent objects that one who suffers should only prevent the suffering that belongs to him, Śāntideva retorts: “The foot’s suffering is not the hand’s. Why does [the hand] protect [the foot]?” (BCA VIII.99)

Williams (1998b) has attempted to refute Śāntideva’s arguments against egoism, claiming that the concept of suffering or pain makes little sense without a subject or self to feel the suffering. Williams’s refutation has been controversial, provoking Barbra Clayton (Clayton 2001), John Pettit (1999) and Mark Siderits (Siderits 2000) all to defend Śāntideva’s claims.

Why do these arguments appear in the chapter on meditation, when the primary focus of that chapter seems to concern the kind of metaphysical insight that is the topic of the following chapter? Two reasons suggest themselves. First, the arguments prepare the audience for the more imaginatively focused practice of the exchange and self and other. Second, as Crosby and Skilton suggest(1995, 84-5), these meditations derive from Cittamātra (Yogācāra) metaphysical views on the ultimate equivalence of self and other.   Śāntideva considers these Cittamātra views to be only a step on the road to the highest Madhyamaka view (see BCA IX). These arguments, then,  are really true only at the level of conventional truth, not at the level of wordless ultimate reality, the object of real metaphysical insight.

ii. Exchange of Self and Other

The last meditation in the chapter is called the exchange of self and other (parātmaparivartana). In it, Śāntideva attempts to put the equalization of self and other into practice, even taking it a step further to dissolve all the meditator’s vestiges of egoism. Here he urges his readers to create “a sense of self in inferiors and others, and a sense of other in oneself,” (VIII.140) to literally form a concept of “I” (ahamkāra) with respect to others, just as one would do with respect to the “drops of semen and blood” (VIII.158) which created the entity that one would normally consider a self. The intervening verses manifest this idea in practice. Here Śāntideva switches pronouns and grammatical persons so that the third person refers to the meditator and the first person to “others.” The new “I” that is the others can then feel envy and contempt toward the “he” that was oneself.

One now imagines how “he” — that is, oneself — seems happy, wealthy and praised, while “I” — others — “am” miserable, poor and despised; “I” should envy “him” (BCA VIII.141-2). Having imagined oneself from the viewpoint of an envious inferior, one then imagines the inverse viewpoint of a contemptuous superior:

We joyous ones see him finally mistreated, and the mocking laughter of all the people here and there. That wretch even had a rivalry with me! . . . Even if he were to have wealth, we should take it forcibly, having given him a mere pittance, if he does any work for us. And he should be caused to fall from happiness. (BCA VIII.150-4)

This sadomasochistic advice and the play of pronouns work together to end  feelings of egoism or attachment to self. Meditating in this way, one comes to live entirely for others.

iii. Meditations Against the Three Poisons

The above meditations from the BCA, while Śāntideva’s most famous, are not the only meditations that he prescribes. In the ŚS, after briefly advising solitude and the control of thoughts, Śāntideva presents in turn three meditations intended to counter the three mental “poisons” which, in Buddhist thought, are responsible for suffering: desire (rāga), anger (dveṣa) and delusion (moha).

Against desire, Śāntideva describes a meditation on the foulness of the body, as in the BCA (ŚS 209-12).  To counteract anger, Śāntideva prescribes the practice of friendliness or love (maitrī, ŚS 212-19). This practice takes a number of forms, but the most notable is the redirection (parināmanā) of good karma toward others’ benefit. (This will be discussed below under “good and bad karma.”) Such acts are discussed at a number of places in Śāntideva’s texts; at ŚS 213-16 he specifically refers to the practice of friendliness, which is intended to counteract anger. The way that one redirects good karma, in practice, is through an expressly stated wish: for example, “Whoever is suffering distress of body or mind in any of the ten directions — may they obtain oceans of happiness and joy through my good karma” (BCA X.2). This rationale for karmic redirection could apply even to those skeptical whether a supernatural process of karmic causality will actually work: by regularly wishing that one’s own good deeds will benefit others’ well-being, one can at least diminish the anger that one feels toward them.

Finally, to counteract delusion, one meditates on dependent origination (pratītyasamutpāda), the Buddhist theory that all things come to exist in dependence upon other causes (ŚS 219-28). This meditation leads into Śāntideva’s discussion of the final perfection, metaphysical insight.

f. Metaphysical Insight

The sixth and final perfection in Śāntideva’s thought is prajñā, a complex term which this article renders as “metaphysical insight.” The term “insight” emphasizes the depth and transformative nature of this knowledge — as we will see, Śāntideva makes strong claims about the effects that prajñā has on its possessor, so that it is classified as a perfection alongside patient endurance and restrained good conduct. The term “metaphysical” emphasizes the specific content of this knowledge: claims about the nature of reality. This is a relatively loose and nontechnical sense of the term “metaphysics” that one may find in introductory textbooks on philosophy — for example, “Metaphysics is the attempt to say what reality is” (Solomon 2006, 113). This section begins with a discussion of the ideas and arguments that Śāntideva includes as the content of metaphysical insight, and then proceeds to discuss their significance for ethics and the conduct of life.

i. Content

Śāntideva’s views on metaphysics follow those of the Madhyamaka school of thought, associated with Nāgārjuna. (See Nagarjuna and Madhyamaka Buddhism for more detail.) For Madhyamaka, all things, especially the self, are empty (śūnya) and dependently originated (pratītyasamutpanna) — they have no essential or abiding existence. Tibetan tradition has typically associated Śāntideva with the more radical Prāsangika Mādhyamika school, as his metaphysical arguments follow their approach of reductio ad absurdum (prasanga) argument rather than the independent syllogisms (svatantra) of the Svātantrika school. On the other hand, Akira Saito (1996, 261) has argued that “we cannot be too careful” in using the term Prāsangika with reference to Śāntideva.  (See McClintock and Dreyfus 2002 for a discussion of the distinction between the Prāsangika and Svātantrika schools.)

Śāntideva’s metaphysics is widely studied and commented on, both in Tibetan tradition and in the West. (For Tibetan commentaries see Dalai Lama XIV 1988; Palden and Seunam 1993. For Western commentaries see Oldmeadow 1994; Sweet 1977.) Nevertheless, the content of Śāntideva’s metaphysics does not seem particularly original; as Michael Sweet’s book-length study of Śāntideva’s metaphysics notes,

we do not find that his philosophical concerns or patterns of argumentation differ in any significant manner from those of Nāgārjuna, and especially from those of Candrakīrti, the great systematizer of the Prāsangika-Mādhyamika who preceded Śāntideva by at least a century. (Sweet 1977, 14)

Where Śāntideva’s approach innovates is in the way that he draws ethical conclusions directly from his metaphysical premises. Many Buddhist texts draw soteriological conclusions of some sort from metaphysical premises — the nature of the universe is such that everyday life is filled with suffering but one can be liberated from it. Moreover, texts often draw ethical conclusions from these soteriological ideas. So in earlier texts there is an indirect connection from metaphysics to ethics by way of soteriology. Śāntideva, on the other hand, argues directly from metaphysics to advice about conduct in life, in a way that is relatively unusual in South Asian Buddhist literature. One exception is Candrakīrti himself, who derives ethical conclusions from metaphysics in his Catuhṣataka commentary (see Lang 2003), though his approach to doing so is significantly different from Śāntideva’s.

Śāntideva’s prasanga arguments avoid foundational claims, in the stricter sense of attempts to definitively establish a position from which other claims can be deduced. Any such position would itself be considered empty and therefore in some sense flawed. Indeed, an earlier Madhyamaka text, the Vigrahavyāvartani of Nāgārjuna, famously refuted its opponents by proclaiming: “If I had any position, then I would have a flaw [in my argument]. But I have no position; therefore I have no flaw at all” (VV 29). Rather, the approach is intended to be purely dialectical and critical, examining alternative positions and knocking them down, as Śāntideva does in BCA IX. Because Śāntideva is deconstructing concepts and deriving ethical significance from this deconstruction, William Edelglass (2007) compares his philosophy to that of Emmanuel Lévinas.

Claims to have no position may seem absurd at first glance, especially when associated with a thinker like Śāntideva who seems to make many positive claims about how one should live. Śāntideva’s response relies on the central Madhyamaka distinction between conventional (samvriti) and ultimate (paramārtha) truth (e.g. BCA IX.2). The ultimate truth is inexpressible (anabhilāpya), untaught (adeṣita) and unmanifest (aprakāśita, ŚS 256); it is nonconceptual, and therefore nonrational. But because we are caught up in illusion, seeing substance, we still need to make provisional statements at a conventional level to make ourselves and others aware of this illusion and free ourselves from it. Since the ultimate truth is inexpressible, all of Śāntideva’s actual claims need to be understood at the conventional level.

The above is what Śāntideva appears to say in his own words, at any rate. It is worth noting here that the Tibetan dGe lugs (Geluk) school argues that such claims cannot be taken literally and that in fact the ultimate truth is accessible to the intellect, although other commentators from the Sa skya (Sakya) and rNying ma (Nyingma) schools accept a more literal interpretation like the one I have just provided (Sweet 1977, 20).

The distinction between ultimate and conventional truth lends support to a number of Śāntideva’s practical arguments. Especially, it supports his self-interested case for altruism on the grounds of the bodhisattva’s happiness: “All who are suffering in the world [are suffering] because of desire for their own happiness. All who are happy in the world [are happy] because of desire for others’ happiness” (BCA VIII.129). Śāntideva does not explain how this psychological claim is supposed to work. Lele (2007, 65-6) ties the claim to Śāntideva’s theory of nonattachment (aparigraha); concern for oneself and one’s own particular interests leads to painful feelings of grief, loss, and fear when, as inevitably happens, those interests are harmed. But however such arguments are supposed to work, they would seem to be undercut by another claim of Śāntideva’s: namely, that bodhisattvas still suffer in a sense, because of their compassion for others. He claims: “Just as one whose body is on fire has no joy at all, even through all pleasures, exactly so there is no way to joy with respect to the distress of beings, for those made of compassion” (BCA VI.123; see also ŚS 156, 166).

The distinction between conventional and ultimate, however, helps one resolve this apparent problem — for the claim that bodhisattvas suffer is made merely at the conventional level of truth. Śāntideva argues that suffering itself is unreal (BCA IX.88-91); and only one who realizes the ultimate truth, it seems, will be able to really recognize this unreality. This recognition is the way in which it is possible for suffering to end, as the Third Noble Truth of Buddhism promises. It is also probably part of the reason that Śāntideva proclaims that happy people are happy because they desire others’ happiness — a bodhisattva, who has lost the illusion of self, can also lose the illusion of suffering and thereby escape it.

If suffering is unreal, however, one may wonder why it should be prevented. A similar worry applies to good and bad karma. Śāntideva claims, after all, that good and bad karma themselves arise out of illusion (BCA IX.11); like everything else we can speak of, they are ultimately empty. Clayton (2006, 97-8) argues that this point implies that ethical action, good karma, or eliminating suffering are unnecessary or insignificant. She quotes Richard Hayes (1994, 38) to the effect that maintaining a sense of the importance of ethics in such a philosophy is merely “philosophical rigour and integrity being compromised by the perceived need to preserve a social institution.” She finds herself “not quite cynical enough” to doubt Śāntideva’s sincerity in accordance with Hayes’s quote, but provides no alternative explanation for why Śāntideva might have still believed in ethical action. Lele (2007, 89-90) argues to the contrary that Śāntideva maintains his philosophical integrity through the conventional-ultimate distinction. Ultimately good and bad karma are unreal, but they are very real at the conventional level. Most people remain trapped in the conventional level, where suffering occurs, and so they experience the suffering as real. For them, it is this conventional level of truth that matters.

ii. Practical Implications

Metaphysical insight has three major ethical and soteriological implications for Śāntideva, some of which we have already seen. First, knowing the nonexistence of self will lead one to benefit others. Second, one who knows dependent origination can become more patient with others’ wrongdoing, because he will know to avoid blaming them. Finally, “one who knows emptiness is not emotionally attached to worldly phenomena, because he is independent [of them]” (ŚS 264); recognizing the emptiness of things allows one to attach less significance to them.

These implications, for Śāntideva, are not merely a matter of logical implication. There is also a practical, cause-and-effect relationship between one’s realization of the metaphysical claims and one’s actions and mental states. For this reason Luis Gómez (1994, 121) notes that the closing verses of BCA IX “leave no room for doubt that we are dealing with a technology of the self” which is also a philosophical discourse. The passage quoted above does not merely state that one who knows emptiness also knows that he should not be emotionally attached to worldly phenomena; it states further that he himself is not in fact so attached (na samhriyate). Elsewhere in the text Śāntideva makes other, similar, causal claims that metaphysical insight will cause one to feel and act differently. For example, after having made a series of logical arguments for the equivalence of self and other, he immediately comes to add: “Those whose mental dispositions are developed in this way (evam), for whom the suffering of others is equal to their loves, go down into the Avīci hell like geese [into] a lotus pond” (BCA VIII.107, emphasis added). The “in this way” (Sanskrit evam) indicates that the logical arguments themselves are a way to develop mental dispositions; hearing these arguments is the thing that develops one’s mind to treat others’ suffering equally to one’s own. Metaphysical insight is not merely an idea added to a stock of knowledge, with which one can do as one pleases; it has direct consequences for one’s emotional states.

Such a view seems perplexing to contemporary Western ears, including some informed by Buddhism. Understanding ideas often seems not to have this liberating effect. David Burton puts the problem well, in terms of his personal experience:

I do not seem to be ignorant about the impermanence of entities. I appear to understand that entities have no fixed essence and that they often change in disagreeable ways. I seem to understand that what I possess will fall out of my possession. I apparently accept that all entities must pass away. And I seem to acknowledge that my craving causes suffering. Yet I am certainly not free from craving and attachment. . . . How, then, might one preserve the common Buddhist claim that knowledge of the three characteristics of existence [i.e. nonself, impermanence and suffering] results in liberation in the face of this objection? (Burton 2004, 31)

Burton explores several potential hypotheses to resolve his question. He labels the hypothesis which seems to come closest to Śāntideva’s view as “insufficient attentiveness and reflection.” That is, that for those who have not experienced the beneficial ethical, emotional or soteriological consequences that are presumed to accrue from knowledge of Buddhist ideas, their belief in such ideas “is something they have thought about from time to time perhaps, but they do not bring it to mind often enough” (Burton 2004, 48-9).

Śāntideva suggests such a hypothesis in two ways. First, he frequently mentions the shifting and changing nature of the mind; for example, he notes that the mind is “like a river flow, unstable, broken up and dissolved when produced,” and “like lightning, unsteadily cut off in a moment” (ŚS 234). Second, within the chapter of the BCA on metaphysical insight, he speaks of “cultivating,” or meditating on, arguments: “this reasoning (vicāra) is meditated on as an antidote to that [fixation on imagination]” (BCA IX.92). This point is reinforced elsewhere in the text; as we have seen, his most famous metaphysical argument, on the equivalence of self and other (BCA VIII.90-119), occurs in the context of a particular meditation, within the BCA’s chapter on meditation (dhyāna). It is not enough, for Śāntideva, to find an argument persuasive and then move on to other things; it must be fixed in one’s mind.

6. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Works

BCA — Śāntideva, Bodhicaryāvatāra. Edition: Bodhicaryāvatāra of Śāntideva with the commentary Pañjikā of Prajñākaramati; ed. P.L. Vaidya (1960), Buddhist Sanskrit Texts XII, Darbhanga, India: Mithila Institute. References given are to chapter and verse numbers.

BCAP — Prajñākaramati, Bodhicaryāvatārapañjikā. Edition: Bodhicaryāvatāra of Śāntideva with the commentary Pañjikā of Prajñākaramati; ed. P.L. Vaidya (1960), Buddhist Sanskrit Texts XII, Darbhanga, India: Mithila Institute. Page references given are to the Poussin edition (listed with “P” in the Vaidya edition’s margins).

NE — Aristotle, Nicomachean Ethics. Edition: J. Bywater, available for download and online search at www.perseus.tufts.edu as of 14 Aug 2007.

ŚS — Śāntideva, Śikṣāsamuccaya. Edition: Çikshāsamuccaya: a compendium of Buddhistic teachings, compiled by Çāntideva chiefly from earlier Mahāyāna sūtras; ed. Cecil Bendall (1970), Bibliotheca Buddhica I, Osnabruck, Germany: Biblio Verlag.

ŚSK — Śāntideva, Śikṣāsamuccaya Kārikā, in the Bendall edition of the ŚS above.

VV — Nāgārjuna, Vigrahavyāvartani. Edition: Vigrahavyāvartani of Nāgārjuna: Sanskrit Text, eds. Christian Lindtner and Richard Mahoney (2003), available for download at http://indica-et-buddhica.org as of 14 Aug 2007.

b. Translations Cited

• Bendall, Cecil. 1970. Introduction. In Çikshāsamuccaya: A Compendium of Buddhistic Teaching Compiled By Çāntideva Chiefly From Earlier Mahāyāna-Sūtras. Osnabrück: Biblio Verlag.
• Crosby, Kate, and Andrew Skilton. 1995. The Bodhicaryāvatāra: A New Translation. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Wallace, Vesna A., and B. Alan Wallace, eds. 1997. A Guide to the Bodhisattva Way of Life. Ithaca, NY: Snow Lion.

c. General Studies of Śāntideva

• Brassard, Francis. 2000. The Concept of Bodhicitta in Śāntideva’s Bodhicaryāvatāra. Albany, NY: State University of New York Press.
• Clayton, Barbra. 2006. Moral Theory in Śāntideva’s Śikṣāsamuccaya: Cultivating the Fruits of Virtue. London and New York: RoutledgeCurzon.
• Cooper, David E., ed. 1998. Ethics: The Classic Readings. Oxford: Blackwell Publishers.
• Dayal, Har. 1970. The Bodhisattva Doctrine in Buddhist Sanskrit Literature. Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass.
• Griffiths, Paul J. 1999. Religious Reading: The Place of Reading in the Practice of Religion. Oxford, UK: Oxford University Press.
• Gyatso, Geshe Kelsang. 1986. Meaningful to Behold: A Commentary to Shantideva’s Guide to the Bodhisattva’s Way of Life. London: Tharpa Publications.
• Harvey, Peter. 2000. An Introduction to Buddhist Ethics: Foundations, Values and Issues. Cambridge, UK: Cambridge University Press.
• Hedinger, Jürg. 1984. Aspekte der Schulung in der Laufbahn eines Bodhisattva: Dargestellt nach dem Śikṣāsamuccaya des Śāntideva. Wiesbaden: Otto Harrassowitz.
• Lele, Amod. 2007. Ethical Revaluation in the Thought of Śāntideva. Unpublished PhD dissertation, Harvard University.
• Mahoney, Richard. 2002. Of the Progress of the Bodhisattva: The Bodhisattvamārga in the Śikṣāsamuccaya. University of Canterbury.
• Pezzali, Amalia. 1968. Śāntideva: Mystique Bouddhiste Des Viie Et Viiie Siècles. Florence: Vallecchi Editore.
• Rinpoche, Thrangu. 2002. A Guide to the Bodhisattva’s Way of Life of Shantideva: A Commentary. Delhi: Sri Satguru Publications.
• Tobden, Geshe Yeshe. 2005. The Way of Awakening: A Commentary on Shantideva’s Bodhicharyavatara. Somerville, MA: Wisdom.
• Williams, Paul. 1995. General Introduction: Śāntideva and His World. In The Bodhicaryāvatāra. Ed. Kate Crosby, and Andrew Skilton, Oxford: Oxford University Press.

d. Specialized Studies

• Clayton, Barbra. 2001. Compassion as a Matter of Fact: The Argument From No-Self to Selflessness in Śāntideva’s Śikṣāsamuccaya. Contemporary Buddhism 2 (1): 83-97.
• Dalai Lama XIV. 1988. Transcendent Wisdom: A Commentary on the Ninth Chapter of Śāntideva’s Guide to the Bodhisattva Way of Life. Ithaca, NY: Snow Lion.
• de Jong, J.W. 1975. La légende de Śāntideva. Indo-Iranian Journal 16 (3): 161-82.
• de Rachewiltz, Igor. 1996. The Mongolian Tanjur Version of the Bodhicaryāvatāra, Edited and Transcribed, With a Word-Index and a Photo-Reproduction of the Original Text (1748). Wiesbaden, Germany: Harrassowitz.
• Edelglass, William. 2007. Ethics and the Subversion of Conceptual Reification in Lévinas and Śāntideva. In Deconstruction and the Ethical in Asian Thought. Ed. Youru Wang, London and New York: Routledge.
• Gómez, Luis O. 1994. Presentations of Self: Personal Dimensions of Ritualized Speech. In Other Selves: Autobiography and Biography in Cross-Cultural Perspective. Ed. Phyllis Granoff, and Koichi Shinohara, Oakville, ON and Buffalo, NY: Mosaic Press.
• Gómez, Luis O. 1999. The Way of the Translators: Three Recent Translations of Śāntideva’s Bodhicaryāvatāra. Buddhist Literature 1 262-354.
• Goodman, Charles. 2008. Consequentialism, Agent-Neutrality, and Mahāyāna Ethics. Philosophy East and West 58 (1): 17-35.
• Harrison, Paul. 2007. The Case of the Vanishing Poet: New Light on Śāntideva and the Śikṣā-Samuccaya. In Festschrift für Michael Hahn, zum 65. Geburtstag von Freunden und Schülern Überreicht. Ed. Konrad Klaus, and Jens-Uwe Hartmann. Vienna: Arbeitskreis für Tibetische und Buddhistische Studien.
• Kanaoka, S. 1963. Regional Characteristics of Mongolian Buddhism: A Study on the Basis of the “Bodhicaryāvatāra”. Bukkyo Shigaku 10 (4): 15-24.
• Palden, Khentchen Kunzang, and Minyak Kunzang Seunam. 1993. Comprendre La Vacuité: Deux Commentaires Du Chapitre Ix De La Marche Vers L’éveil De Shāntideva. Peyzac-le-Moustier, France: Éditions Padmakara.
• Mrozik, Susanne. 1998. The Relationship Between Morality and the Body in Monastic Training According to the Śikṣāsamuccaya. Harvard University.
• Mrozik, Susanne. 2007. Virtuous Bodies: The Physical Dimensions of Morality in Buddhist Ethics. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Oldmeadow, P.R. 1994. A Study of the Wisdom Chapter (Prajñāparamitā Pariccheda) of the Bodhicaryāvatārapañjikā of Prajñākaramati. Australian National University.
• Onishi, Kaoru. 2003. The Bodhicaryāvatāra and Its Monastic Aspects: On the Problem of Representation. University of Michigan.
• Pettit, John. 1999. Altruism and Reality: Studies in the Philosophy of the Bodhicharyavatara. Journal of Buddhist Ethics 6.
• Saito, Akira. 1993. A Study of Akṣayamati (=Śāntideva)’s Bodhisattvacaryāvatāra as Found in the Tibetan Manuscripts From Tun-Huang. Faculty of Humanities, Miye University.
• Saito, Akira. 1996. Śāntideva in the History of Mādhyamika Philosophy. In Buddhism in India and Abroad: An Integrating Influence in Vedic and Post-Vedic Perspective. Ed. Kalpakam Sankarnarayan, Motohiro Yoritomi, and Shubhada A. Joshi. Mumbai: Somaiya Publications Pvt. Ltd.
• Siderits, Mark. 2000. The Reality of Altruism: Reconstructing Śāntideva. Philosophy East and West 50 (3): 412-24.
• Siderits, Mark. 2005. Freedom, Caring and Buddhist Philosophy. Contemporary Buddhism 6 (2): 87-113.
• Sweet, Michael J. 1977. Śāntideva and the Mādhyamika: The Prajñāpāramitā-Pariccheda of the Bodhicaryāvatāra. University of Wisconsin-Madison.
• Sweet, Michael J. 1996. Mental Purification (Blo Sbyong): A Native Tibetan Genre of Religious Literature. In Tibetan Literature: Studies in Genre. Ed. José Ignacio Cabezón, and Roger R. Jackson. Ithaca, NY: Snow Lion.
• Thurman, Robert A.F. 2004. Anger: The Seven Deadly Sins. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Williams, Paul. 1998a. Altruism and Reality: Studies in the Philosophy of the Bodhicaryāvatāra. Richmond, UK: Curzon Press.
• Williams, Paul. 1998b. The Absence of Self and the Removal of Pain: How Śāntideva Destroyed the Bodhisattva Path. In Altruism and Reality: Studies in the Philosophy of the Bodhicaryāvatāra, Richmond, UK: Curzon Press.

e. Related Interest

• Burton, David. 2004. Buddhism, Knowledge, and Liberation: A Philosophical Analysis of Suffering. Aldershot, England; Burlington, VT: Ashgate.
• Chang, Garma C.C., ed. 1991. A Treasury of Mahāyāna Sūtras: Selections From the Mahāratnakūṭa Sūtra. Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass.
• Harrison, Paul. 1987. Who Gets to Ride in the Great Vehicle? Self-Image and Identity Among Followers of the Early Mahāyāna. Journal of the International Association of Buddhist Studies 10 (2): 67-89.
• Hayes, Richard. 1994. The Analysis of Karma in Vasubandhu’s Abhidharmakośabhāṣya. In Hermeneutical Paths to the Sacred Worlds of India. Ed. Katherine K. Young, Atlanta: Scholars Press.
• Heim, Maria. 2004. Theories of the Gift in South Asia: Hindu, Buddhist and Jain Reflections on Dāna. New York and Oxford: Routledge.
• Hibbets, Maria. 2000. The Ethics of Esteem. Journal of Buddhist Ethics 7 26-42.
• Kajiyama, Yuichi. 1989. Transfer and Transformation of Merits in Relation to Emptiness. In Studies in Buddhist Philosophy (Selected Papers). Ed. Katsumi Minaki. Kyoto: Rinsen Book Co.
• Keown, Damien. 2005. Buddhism: Morality Without Ethics? In Buddhist Studies From India to America: Essays in Honor of Charles S. Prebish. Ed. Damien Keown. London: Routledge.
• Lang, Karen. 2003. Four Illusions: Candrakīrti’s Advice to Travelers on the Bodhisattva Path. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• MacIntyre, Alasdair. 1966. A Short History of Ethics: A History of Moral Philosophy From the Homeric Age to the Twentieth Century. New York: Touchstone.
• McClintock, Sara, and Georges Dreyfus, eds. 2002. The Svātantrika-Prāsaṅgika Distinction: What Difference Does a Difference Make? Somerville, MA: Wisdom Publiccations.
• Nattier, Jan. 2003. A Few Good Men: The Bodhisattva Path According to the Inquiry of Ugra (Ugraparipṛcchā). Honolulu: University of Hawai’i Press.
• Parfit, Derek. 1984. Reasons and Persons. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Pye, Michael. 1978. Skilful Means: A Concept in Mahayana Buddhism. London: Duckworth.
• Solomon, Robert C. 2006. The Big Questions: A Short Introduction to Philosophy. Belmont, CA: Thomson Wadsworth.
• Sprung, Mervyn. 1979. Lucid Exposition of the Middle Way: The Essential Chapters From the Prasannapadā of Candrakīrti. Boulder, CO: Prajñā Press.
• Tatz, Mark. 1994. The Skill in Means (Upāyakauśalya) Sūtra. Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass.
• Wilson, Liz. 1996. Charming Cadavers: Horrific Figurations of the Feminine in Indian Buddhist Hagiographic Literature. Chicago: University of Chicago Press.

Author Information

Bhartrihari (c. 450—510 C.E.)

Bhartrihari may be considered one of the most original philosophers of language and religion in ancient India. He is known primarily as a grammarian, but his works have great philosophical significance, especially with regard to the connections they posit between grammar, logic, semantics, and ontology. His thought may be characterized as part of the shabdadvaita (word monistic) school of thought, which asserts that cognition and language at an ultimate level are ontologically identical concepts that refer to one supreme reality, Brahman. Bhartrihari interprets the notion of the originary word (shabda) as transcending the bounds of spoken and written language and meaning. Understood as shabda tattva-the “word principle,” this complex idea explains the nature of consciousness, the awareness of all forms of phenomenal appearances, and posits an identity obtains between these, which is none other than Brahman. It is thus language as a fundamentally ontological principle that accounts for how we are able to conceptualize and communicate the awareness of objects. The metaphysical notion of shabda Brahman posits the unity of all existence as the foundation for all linguistically designated individual phenomena.

Bhartrihari’s theory of language recognizes that meaning is conveyed in formalist terms where meaning is organized along syntactical rules. But it makes the leap, not made by modern Western philosophers, that such a view of language does not merely serve our mundane communicative purposes and see to the achievement of practical goals, but leads to paramount metaphysical knowledge and salvation.

Table of Contents

1. Bhartrihari’s Life and Works
2. Early Grammarians and Philosophical Semantics
3. Brahman, Language, and the World
4. Bhartrihari’s Grammar
5. The Sphota Theory of Language
6. Phenomenology of Language and the Concept of Shabda–Brahman
7. Bhartrihari and Western Philosophy
8. References and Further Reading

1. Bhartrihari’s Life and Works

Bhartrihari’s works were so widely known that even the Chinese traveler Yijing (I-Tsing) (635-713 CE) mentions the grammarian-philosopher, mistaking him for a Buddhist. Unfortunately, we do not know much about his personal history and his works do not throw much light on the matter. There are some narratives referring to his background but they are not supported by historical data. In these somewhat dubious accounts, he is said to have been existentially torn between two kinds of life: the path of pleasure and that of the monastic yogi. Although he believed that he should renounce the world of material pleasures (reflected in poetry attributed to him by scholars), it took many attempts to finally achieve the life of dispassion. His hedonism and philosophical acumen led him, according to his legend, to produce works of great breadth, depth and beauty.

Bhartrihari credits some of the theories in his work Vâkyapadîya to his teacher, who was probably one of Candrâcârya’s contemporaries, Vasurata. To be more precise, the noted scholar T.R.V. Murti proposes the following chronology: Vasurata, followed by Bhartrihari (450-510 CE) and Dinnâga (Dignâga) (480-540 CE). Among the major works attributed to Bhartrihari are his main philosophical treatise, Vâkyapadîya (On Sentences and Words) kândas I, II, and III, Mahâbhâshyatîkâ (a commentary on the Mahâbhâshya of Patanjali), Vâkyapadîyavrtti (a commentary on the Vâkyapadîya kândas I and II), and shabdadhâtusamîksha. Since 1884, the Vâkyapadîya, containing approximately 635 verses, has been edited and published several times in English translation.

The first two chapters of the Vâkyapadîya discuss the nature of creation, the relationship of Brahman, world, language, the individual soul (jîva), and the manifestation and comprehension of the meanings of words and sentences. In addition, the literary works attributed by some to Bhartrihari (not mentioned here) have made an impact on the growing popular Hindu devotional (bhakti) movements. More importantly, his philosophical work was recognized and addressed by schools of Hindu scriptural exegesis (Mîmâmsâ), Vedânta (mystical Vedism) and Buddhism.

2. Early Grammarians and Philosophical Semantics

In ancient India, grammarians saw their task as establishing the foundations of the Vedas, but their work often resulted in the development of their own philosophical systems. Patanjali, in his Mahâbhâshya, explains that the study of grammar (vyâkaranam) was meant to maintain the truth of the Vedas, to guide the use of Vedic speech in ritual contexts, and to aid in the clear interpretations of individual human speech. Both Pânini and Patanjali, two major Sanksrit grammarians, were the first to provide a systematic and formal analysis of the grammatical bases of all intended meanings. Pânini (7th century BCE) developed the Ashtâdhyâyî (Eight-Chapters) for the grammarians. This impressive work contains a thorough analysis of the rules of Sanskrit language down into its nominal and verbal components; it contains a science of language, applicable to the Vedas, also comprised of sets of operational rules and meta -rules that interpret the former. Among these “rules for interpretation” of Vedic texts, we are given a “universal grammar. Pânini’s approach is not like the Mîmâmsâ, which focuses on the study of Vedic language. Instead, Pânini deals with spoken and Vedic languages as if they are of the same genre.

Pânini’s Ashtâdhyâyî, its commentaries, and the Vâkyapadîya of Bhartrihari are said to constitute the fundamental texts for the school of Pânini’s grammar, whose object of study was ultimately Vedic. Around 150 BCE, Patanjali wrote the Mahâbhâshya, an interpretation of some of Pânini’s rules written in dialogue form, and it is this work that is the basis for later commentaries on grammar and philosophy. It is of interest to note here that the Dharmashâstras or Treatises on Law, including the well-known Laws of Manu, were composed between 322 and 183 BCE. J.N. Mohanty points out that these treatises can be seen as attempts on the part of orthodox Brahminism to preserve itself against the anti-Vedic philosophies. However, he considers Pânini’s grammar and Patanjali’s commentary to carry greater weight in the Indian philosophical tradition.

With the Vâkyapadîya, Bhartrihari moves grammatical analysis squarely into the realm of philosophy, arguing that grammar can be consider a darshana, a “view,” or an official philosophical school, providing perspective and insight into ultimate reality. The first verse articulates the fundamental view of his newly envisaged school:

The Brahman is without beginning and end, whose essence is the Word, who is the cause of the manifested phonemes, who appears as the objects, from whom the creation of the world proceeds.

It is the project of the Vâkyapadîya to explain this verse, with all of its philosophical, linguistic, and metaphysical implications. At base, we contextualize Bhartrihari’s philosophical inquiry into language as being conditioned by the Indian culture and scriptural tradition, in which this type of intellectual pursuit had a soteriological purpose -the realization of absolute knowledge and the spiritual liberation which ensues; thus, it is a distinctively ontological reflection on language which Bhartrihari added to the thought of earlier grammarians.

3. Brahman, Language, and the World

The Brahminic view of the cosmos put forth in the Vedas is one of constant and cyclical creation and dissolution. At the dissolution of each creative cycle a seed or trace (samskâra) is left behind out of which the next cycle arises. What is significant here is that the nature of the seed from which each cycle of creation bursts forth is expressed as “Divine Word” (Daivi Vâk). If language is of divine origin, it can be conceived as Being Brahman expressing and embodying itself in the plurality of phenomena that is creation.

Bhartrihari considers Brahman, the basis of reality, to be “without beginning and end” (anâdi nidhânam), as a concept that is not subject to the attributes of temporal sequences of events, either externally or in the succession of mental events that form cognitions. The word principle, shabda Brahman, is not defined in terms of the temporal nature of our cognitive states, because it functions as the inherent, primordial ground of all cognitions. Thus, against the Hindu logicians, the Nyâyas, for whom particular forms of human speech may be expressed in conventional terms for practical purposes, language itself is not something which arises or is created in time by God or humans. As B.K. Matilal states, “To talk of an absolute beginning of language is untenable. Language is continuous and co-terminus with human existence or the existence of any sentient being.”

There has been some scholarly debate regarding the meaning of the term “eternal” or “akshara” as Bhartrihari applies it to the word-principle. While some interpret this to refer to an all-pervading entity, existing in opposition to the multiplicity of objects in space and time, others see it as Bhartrihari’s specialized way of referring to phonemes, the minimal units of meaningful sound. It seems that phonemes understood in this way explain how it is the case that Word appears as objects. Eternity is “that which appears as objects, and from whom the creation of the world proceeds.” Phonemes are thus the eternally possible elements that can be combined in inexhaustible ways to manifest the plurality of nature.

This principle accounts for creation on a number of levels: it is the origin of consciousness, of cognition, sensation, language use, cognitive and experiential aspects of the world. In other words, objects of thought and the relations between them are word-determined, regardless of whether they are objects of perception, inference or any other kind of knowledge. When we perceptually apprehend external reality, we always do so in terms of names, for without names objects are neither identifiable nor knowable.

Furthermore, when we consider phenomenal concepts, we see that they do not exist or hold any meaning aside from the words through which they are expressed; we might say that our concepts are “word-loaded” and from this we can infer that the word principle causes the world. Bhartrihari’s causal claim is in keeping with the traditional philosophical discussions on the nature of causality and inference as he applies it to the word-principle:

Just as other thinkers, while explaining causality, saw that the properties of cause continue in the effects….in the same way in the scriptures also, the word in which the power of Enjoyer and Enjoyed are submerged has been declared as the cause of the world.

4. Bhartrihari’s Grammar

In the Vâkyapadîya, kânda I, Bhartrihari defines the scope of his inquiry as the subjects of grammar. Our speech takes the form of the basic structures of language, and grammar deals with this communicatively spoken language. The correct understanding of speech can take us to the limits of our conventional and spiritual capacities, and so language analysis must operate at all the following levels: 1. sentences and words, 2. meanings corresponding to sentences and words, 3. the fitness or compatibility between sound and sense, and 4. the spiritual merit obtained by using the correct language.

In the Sanskrit grammatical tradition, the “elite” are defined as those who use the correct language; we arrive at this standard language by abstracting from communicative language, or “language-in-use.” In his linguistic theory, Bhartrihari distinguishes between two forms of language, the spoken, or “language-in-use” and the analytic. The analytic or formal language emerges from a formal, abstract analysis of communicative language. If we were to gather and compare various sentences and words from different contexts of use, we would logically infer the basic segments (roots, stems, suffixes) that account for a common logical or formal basis of denotation.

This hierarchical conception of language use and language meaning can be understood in the following way, taking off from a representation of Matilal, with the term on the far right of each column understood as the originator of the term in the middle, and the term in the middle being the originator of the term on the left. In other words, Bhartrihari’s conception of utterance and understanding can be grasped with the following schema under the rubric of:

Product	Producer	Derivative Element
Linguistic Components	Language-in-Use	Analytic Language
sound
sentences and words	word stems, suffixes, etc..
sense	sentence meaning and word meaning	stem meaning and suffix meaning
sound and sense relations	fitness compatibility	causality relations
purpose	spiritual merit	correct knowledge

There is debate about the ontological and epistemological status of relations between these levels of language, and Bhartrihari’s commentary on grammar includes a review of several theories and ultimately he seems to favor the “naturalist view.” In the first chapter of the Vâkyapadîya, Bhartrihari explains the naturalist view. Following the pâdavâdins (those who regard the word as the primary indivisible unit) who consider word-constituents, such as roots and suffixes, to be mere fictitious abstractions from words, so also the vâkyavâdins (those who regard the sentence as the indivisible unit) consider words to be imaginary abstractions from the sentence. The naturalists, such as Pânini, believe that language has an invariant form expressed in grammar. They therefore give epistemic primacy to spoken language; formal language is only an “appearance” and secondary aid to understanding. The conventionalists, on the other hand, hold that the analytic language is primary in that it contains within it all the structural features that may be used to create meaningful speech.

5. The Sphota Theory of Language

Bhartrihari’s theory occupies an interesting place in the ongoing Hindu-Buddhist debates about meaning and reference. For the Buddhists, meaning is a function of social and linguistic convention and reference is ultimately a projection of imaginative consciousness. For the Brahminic Nyâyas or Logicians, words have meaning because they refer to external objects; words can be combined in sentences just like things exist in relation to one another in external reality. With Advaita Vedânta, words mask the meaning of the Absolute Self (Âtman) which is Brahman, so that, when a person predicates categories to their identity such as in the sentence “I am tall,” this predication masks the all-inclusive nature of the eternal Self, which is beyond categorization. Bhartrihari puts forth a theory of language which, rather than starting by taking fundamental ontological, epistemological or social sides in these well-established debates, starts from the question of how meaning happens, how it emerges from the acts of both speaker and audience, and, constructing this theory first, what he believes to be appropriate metaphysical, epistemological and soteriological implications are drawn from it.

For Bhartrihari, linguistic meaning cannot be conveyed or accounted for by the physical utterance and perception of sounds, so he puts forth the sphota theory: the theory which posits the meaning-unit, which for him is the sentence, as a single entity. The term “sphota” dates back to Pânini’s reference to “sphotâyana” in his treatise Ashtâdhyâyî, however it was Patanjali who explicitly discusses sphota in his Mahâbhâshya. According to him sphota signifies spoken language, with the audible sound (dhvani) as its special quality. In Bhartrihari’s treatment of this concept, while the audible noise may vary depending on the speaker’s mode of utterance, sphota as the meaning unit of speech is not subject to such variations. This is so because for Bhartrihari, meaning is conveyed by the sentence. To explicate this theory, Bhartrihari depends on the root of sphota, namely sphut, meaning “to burst forth…” as in the “idea that spews forth” (in an internal mental state) when a meaningful sound, the sentence as a whole, is uttered.

The meaning of the sentence, the speech-unit, is one entire cognitive content (samvit). The sentence is indivisible (akhanda) and owes its cognitive value to the meaning-whole. Thus, its meaning is not reducible to its parts, the individual words which are distinguished only for the purposes of convention or expression. The differentiated word-meanings, which are also ontological categories, are the abstracted “pieces” we produce using imaginative construction, or vikalpa. Sphota entails a kind of mental perception which is described as a moment of recognition, an instantaneous flash (pratibhâ), whereby the hearer is made conscious, through hearing sounds, of the latent meaning unit already present in his consciousness (unconscious). The sentence employs analyzable units to express its meaning, but that meaning emerges out of the particular concatenation of those units, not because those units are meaningful in themselves. We analyze language by splitting it up into words, prefixes, suffixes, etc….but this is indicative of the fact that we “misunderstand” the fundamental oneness of the speech-unit. Words are only abstracted meaning possibilities in this sense, whereas the uttered sentence is the realization of a meaning-whole irreducible to those parts in themselves. This fundamental unity seems to apply, also, to any language taken as a whole. Matilal explains: “it is only those who do not know the language thoroughly who analyze it into words, in order to get a connected meaning.” As this scholar suggests, it is rather remarkable that Bhartrihari’s recognition of the theoretical indivisibility of the sentence resonates with the contemporary linguistic view of learning sentences as wholes (at a later stage of development we build new sentences from learned first sentences through analogical reasoning).

Sphota is therefore the cause of manifested language, which is meant to convey meaning. Sphota is more specifically identified as the underlying totality of linguistic capability, or “potency” and secondarily as the cause of two differentiated aspects of manifested meaning: applied meaning expressed as dhvani, the audible sound patterns of speech and artha-language as meaning-bearing. The grammatical/syntactical parts of the underlying sphota can only be heard and understood through its phonetic elements. Bhartrihari explains that the apparent difference between sphota and dhvani arises as we utter words. Initially, the word exists in the mind of the speaker as a unity but is manifested as a sequence of different sounds-thus giving the appearance of differentiation. dhvanis may be more specifically described as merely the audible possibility of meaning, a necessary but hardly sufficient condition of meaning.

We might think of this unit of linguistic potency, the sphota, as the cognitive/propositional whole content of meaning that can be transposed into different languages, while the actual word-sounds comprise the contents of the “speech-act”. But what holds the act to its ability to convey intended meanings? The words sounded by a plurality of speakers comprise the physical manifestation of vâk or vaikharî–vâk and it is upon this form of vâk that physical objects as objective forms are modeled. The unity that underlies these objective referents and meanings, however, is known as the intuited vâk–pashyati–vâk, which makes possible the unmediated understanding of a complete linguistic expression. This intuitive level of understanding, constitutive of the sphota, is teleological in its nature and structure in that it contains all potential possibilities of meaning-bearing dhvanis and their order of manifestation.

But, what guarantees that the hearer of speech properly comprehends what is uttered? In the second book of the Vâkyapadîya, Bhartrihari states:

Sentence meaning is produced by word meanings but is not constituted by them. Its form is that Intuition, that innate “know how” awareness (pratibhâ) possessed by all beings. It is a cognitive state evident to the hearer…not describable or definable, but all practical activities depend on it directly or through recollection of it.

Pratibhâ intuition can be characterized as shabda, the very same speech principle externalized in the utterances of speakers, as it operates within the hearer, causing her to instantaneously comprehend the meaning of the utterance. However, linguistic convention, shared by speaker and hearer, cannot account for the flash of comprehension. If that were the case, we would not have instances where communication breaks down in spite of the shared language between speaker and hearer. The comprehension of meaning lies in the sphota that is already present in the hearer’s awareness. As she hears the succession of audible phonemes, the latent and undifferentiated language potency within her is brought to “fruition” in the form of grasping the speaker’s meaning. Thus, while the audible words are necessary for such verbal comprehension to occur in the hearer, they are not sufficient. It is her own ability to understand meaning referred to by these words, by virtue of sharing the same sphota with the speaker, which completes the act of cognition.

It is at this point that the philosophy of language has for Bhartrihari religious implications of both ontological and interpretive scope. Just as various sentences might sound different in the mouths of different speakers and yet convey the same meanings, various Vedas may seem different in form and style, but there is a unity carried by the underlying sphota, which ensures that it is the same truth, or dharma that is expressed throughout the texts. Bearing in mind that Brahman is the ultimate referent of all speech forms, this higher reality is manifested in the sacred texts-whose efficacy (ritual, soteriological, epistemological) depends upon our ability to correctly apprehend its meaning. The sphota concept makes such interpretation possible. Again, the sphota expresses a meaning-whole behind individual letters and words. The implication for the truth of Vedic discourse is clear, for that truth is already present in the speaker (the Veda) and is potentially present in the consciousness of the hearers (the practitioners).

According to Bhartrihari’s theory, we can justify this particular philosophical method as revelatory by using the concept of shabdapramâna. The implications of this method are explained in the following section; here, we examine the source of our cognitions. But in order for one to give their assent to a worldview that renders to language the cosmic and salvific roles Bhartrihari does, a theory that posits that language is the medium of ultimate knowledge, one must be convinced that language in general has the capacity to yield ordinary knowledge. Given the way Bhartrihari conceptualizes language, as not primarily referent directed, but instead as referent-constructing, we need to look at how the grammarian thematizes the knowledge-conferring power of language within his own peculiarly unique framework.

6. Phenomenology of Language and the Concept of Shabda-Brahman

Sphota may be characterized as the intersubjective, universal “store-house” of meaning, the ground of all linguistic activity and communication. Sphota is the unifying principle that connects the word, the grammatical form of the word, and the meaning. Furthermore, just as words and sentences represent “pieces” of the meaning extracted from the whole, the objects and states of affairs these pieces represent actually refer to a “whole of objects meant” or an entire reality.

In classical Indian thought, objects are thought to be constituted of substance (dravya), but in Bhartrihari and especially in his first major commentator Helârâja, substance can be distinguished into two kinds, the substance of all things, which is Brahman, and the other individual, empirical substances. The empirical notion of substance here may be derived from the grammatical operation of ekashesha, explained by Pânini as using individual word-tokens to refer to individual objects-substances. Thus, names or singular terms are said by the earliest grammarians to refer to one substance at a time, therefore substance is defined through the relation of reference, and the nature of each substance is so specific that we cannot posit any general properties possessed by all of them. For example, each time we say the word ‘cow’ we refer to a different cow, and each cow is actually a different wholly individual entity.

Bhartrihari defines “actual” or empirical substance as that which we refer to by using indexicals and quantifiers, which refer to anything in our ontological reality: ‘this’ ‘that’ ‘something’ or ‘anything.’ The term ‘this’ points out an existence given to perception, while ‘that’ refers to something whose existence can be validated by some other means of knowledge but which is not available to perception. Bhartrihari also acknowledges the pragmatic and common sense view of “substance” as “a relative concept being dependent on our concept of quality (guna). A substance is that which is said to be distinguished and a quality is that which distinguishes the substance.

But Bhartrihari’s contribution to this debate changes the very notion of substance into a much more inclusive and general concept, since anything we refer to using a name or substantive term, even generic properties and verbs, become substances in that they are distinguished by words, as Matilal illustrates: “Thus, cooking would refer to the fact of cooking and ‘walking’ to the fact of walking as long as the speaker intends to distinguish the act of cooking from the act of walking.” “In the third book of the Vâkyapadîya, he defines the concept of ‘quality’/guna as dependent upon, as arising from substance. He rejects the Vaisheshika view that substances and qualities belong to entirely different categories (padârtha-s), and espouses the revolutionary view that the latter arises from the former. For him, qualities, existing in relation to substances serve to further differentiate those substances by “delimiting their scope.” But how does he account for such a radical revisioning?

Bhartrihari’s contribution of his particular theory of the “imaginative construction” of perceptions and language once again emerges within the context of debates with competing theories of knowledge. The Buddhist idealistic claim also argued that the world of experience or phenomena is at base a product of the human imaginative faculty. The Buddhists claim that our cognitive experiences construct our reality; these are modes of consciousness containing cognitive contents and in the final analysis, do not yield any knowledge about reality as it may be outside of themselves. It is consciousness that posits the (apparent) externality of objects, not the “objects themselves.” This form of phenomenal-idealism is developed as a counterclaim to the Hindu realist position, which affirms the existence of external reality. For the Buddhist, objects are only the external contents of the human imagination. Interestingly enough, Bhartrihari’s sphota theory of language and cognition is sometimes understood as an extension of the Buddhist position; according to the grammarian, cognition is entirely language-dependent in that the structure of our cognitive states is determined by grammar. But Bhartrihari’s theory posits knowledge as a matter of specifically linguistic construction. The concept of vikalpa for him implies the following: the structure of language shapes how we categorize the objects of our experience and our descriptions of reality as a whole. Even at the most immediate levels of awareness), we must conceptualize and therefore interpret the contents of sense perception. Thus, at the level of pure sensation, the sensory core is already saturated, as it were, with the “deep structure” of language. In this respect, Bhartrihari’s position differs from the Buddhist position rather dramatically. The Buddhists clearly distinguish between pure perception (nirvikalpa-pratyaksha), which is pre-conceptual, unverbalizable and correspondent to reality, and constructed perception (savikalpa-pratyakasha) that is conceptual and may therefore be considered a verbalized interpretation of the real. For the Buddhist, the pure sensory core is the real locus of perception. Bhartrihari, as an ontological monist, does not distinguish between a pure perception and a constructed perception such that the former is concept-free and ineffable and the latter concept-loaded and autonomously constructed, because he thinks that perception is inherently verbal. Not only are sense data and linguistic units non-different, but they are expressive of the unitary principle of Brahman-which is differentiated into the plurality of linguistic objects that make up the world.

Bhartrihari’s notion of vikalpa is also directed against the early Nyaiyayikas, who, while agreeing on the correspondence between word and thing, uphold the distinction between language and its object-referents. These Hindu Logicians held that the perceptual apprehension of the object could be distinguished from naming the object. For the Nyâyas, who are ontological pluralists and materialists, words refer to distinct generic properties of and relations between objects. Perception is a two-step process involving the initial apprehension of the object and then the subsequent apperception/awareness that results in mental and syntactic/linguistic representations of the first moment of awareness. Here, linguistic categories originate in the different substances and attributes that exist in the world. Bhartrihari counters them by arguing that the act of perception, rather than acquiring linguistic clothing after the bare particular has already been presented to consciousness, can only be aware of the object before it as a ‘this’ or ‘that’, that is, as an awareness of something only as a particular and as such, identifiable. That is to say, significantly enough, that for Bhartrihari, the word makes the thing an individual, and as one moves further and further along the refined categories of what is conventionally known as denotation, the word makes the thing what it is. For Bhartrihari, the difference the Logicians posit between the ontological and the linguistic would make meanings of all kinds, mundane ones and religious ones, contingent on the circumstances and speaker. But if perception is innately verbal, no perilous bridge need be suspended over some supposed abyss between vision and truth, both in our mundane lives and for the rishis who pronounced the Vedas. The word then makes the thing, and Brahman makes the world, and so it is entirely proper to speak of words as the creator of all things (shabda–Brahman).

7. Bhartrihari and Western Philosophy

Although previous Bhartrihari scholarship has progressed rather slowly due to numerous difficulties, within the last decade or so his work has garnered attention from Western scholars. Bhartrihari’s explorations into the relations between language, thought and reality reflect contemporary philosophical concerns with meaning, language use, and communication, particularly in the work of Chomsky, Wittgenstein, Grice, and Austin. His theory of language recognizes that meaning is conveyed in formalist terms where meaning is organized along syntactical rules. But it makes the leap, not made by modern Western philosophers, that such a view of language does not merely serve our mundane communicative purposes and see to the achievement of practical goals, but leads to paramount metaphysical knowledge, a knowledge carrying with it a palpable salvific value.

8. References and Further Reading

• Bhartrihari. The Vâkyapadîya, Critical texts of Cantos I and II with English Translation. Trans. K. Pillai. Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass, 1971.
• Coward, Harold G. The Sphota Theory of Language: A Philosophical Analysis . Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass, 1980.
• Coward, Harold G., and K. Kunjunni Raja, eds. The Philosophy of the Grammarians (Volume V of Encyclopedia of Indian Philosophies, ed. Karl Potter). Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1990.
• Herzberger, Radhika. Bhartrihari and the Buddhists. Dordrecht: D. Reidel/Kluwer Academic Publishers, 1986.
• Houben, Jan E.M. The Sambanda Samuddesha and Bhartrihari’s Philosophy of Language. Groningen: Egbert Forsten, 1995.
• Iyer, Soubramania, K.A. Bhartrihari. A Study of Vâkyapadîya in the Light of Ancient Commentaries. Poona: Deccan College Postgraduate Research Institute, 1997.
• Matilal, B.K. Mind, Language, and World. Ed. J. Ganeri. Delhi: Oxford University Press, 2002. (See “What Bhartrihari Would Have Said About Quine.”)
• Matilal, B.K. The Word and the World: India’s Contribution to the Study of Language. Delhi: Oxford University Press, 1992.
• Matilal, B. K. Perception: An Essay on Classical Indian Theories of Knowledge. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1986. (See chapter 12.)
• Matilal, B.K. Epistemology, Logic, and Grammar in Indian Philosophical Analysis. The Hague: Mouton, 1971.
• Potter, Karl, ed. The Tradition of the Nyâya-Vaisheshika up to Gangesha (Volume II of Encyclopedia of Indian Philosophies, ed. Karl Potter). Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass, 1977.
• Shah, K.J. “Bhartrihari and Wittgenstein.” Perspectives on the Philosophy of Meaning 1/1 (1990): 80-95.

Author Information

Stephanie Theodorou
Email: STheodorou@Immaculata.edu
Immaculata University
U. S. A.

Madhva (1238—1317)

The Dvaita or “dualist” school of Hindu Vedanta philosophy originated in 13th-century South India with Sri Madhvacarya (Madhva). Madhva, who considered himself an avatara of the wind-god Vayu, argued that a body of canonical texts called the “Vedanta” or “end of the Veda” taught the fundamental difference between the individual self or atman and the ultimate reality, brahman. According to Madhva there are two orders of reality: 1. svatantra, independent reality, which consists of Brahman alone and 2. paratantra, dependent reality, which consists of jivas (souls) and jada (lifeless objects). Although dependent reality would not exist apart from brahman’s will, this very dependence creates a fundamental distinction between brahman and all else, implying a dualist view. By interpreting the Vedanta materials (especially the Upanisads, the Bhagavadgita and the Brahmasutras) along these lines, Madhva deliberately challenged the non-dualist reading in which the atman was identified with brahman. Madhva argued that the scriptures could not teach the identity of all beings because this would contradict ordinary perception, which tells us that we are different both from one another and from God. Madhva and his followers call their system tattvavada, “the realist viewpoint”.

Table of Contents

1. Madhva and Sankara
2. Madhva and Ramanuja
3. Dvaita Vedanta
4. Canonical Sources
5. References and Further Reading

1. Madhva and Sankara

The main tenet of Madhva’s Dvaita Vedanta is that the Vedic tradition teaches a fundamental difference between the human soul or atman and the ultimate reality, brahman. This is markedly different from the earlier Advaita Vedanta, which Madhva often vociferously attacked. Sankara’s A-dvaita or “non-dualist” Vedanta (9th century) argued that the atman is completely identical with brahman. According to Sankara, the atman experiences a false sense of plurality and individuality when under the influence of the delusive power of maya. While maya has the ambiguous ontological status of being neither real nor unreal, the only true reality is brahman. A soul becomes liberated from the cycle of rebirth (punar-janma) by realizing that its very experience of samsara is an illusion; its true identity is the singular objectless consciousness that constitutes pure being or brahman.

2. Madhva and Ramanuja

While Ramanuja’s system of Visistadvaita Vedanta or “qualified non-dualism” modifies Sankara’s position on the soul’s identity with brahman, Madhva also rejected it. Ramanuja assumes a plurality of individual souls whose identity remains intact even after liberation but maintains that the souls share the essential nature of brahma. The souls are eternal particles issuing from brahman, who as their source retains its transcendence. Ramanuja maintains Visnu’s distinct difference from the human soul and his supremacy as creator and redeemer. Ramanuja identifies brahman with Visnu, holding that brahman is saguna, i.e. possesses attributes, in contrast to Sankara’s attributeless or “nirguna” brahman.

3. Dvaita Vedanta

Like Ramanuja, Madhva identifies brahman with Visnu. However, he argues that any system that allows for any identification of the atman with brahman undermines Visnu’s supremacy, compromises His status, and strips devotional acts of their meaning. Madhva’s insistence on the modal distinction between the atman and brahman, wherein the former is inalterably dependent upon–and therefore, fundamentally different from–the latter, insures Visnu-as-brahman‘s complete and utter transcendence of the human soul. For Madhva, this view alone makes devotion [bhakti] an essential component of religious belief and practice. Attaining Visnu’s grace is the soul’s only hope of achieving liberation [moksa] from the cycle of rebirth (samsara).

Like Ramanuja, Madhva opposes Sankara’s conception of Brahman as nirguna or without qualities and as a pure self- consciousness. Madhva views Visnu as preeminent above all other deities on the basis of His unique characteristics. This emphasis on Visnu’s particular collocation of attributes that renders Him distinct from all other gods, human souls, and the material world reveals another critical component of Madhva’s philosophy which is his acceptance of an ontological plurality as a fundamental facet of being. Indeed, Madhva rejects the notion that brahman is the only truly existent entity (tattva) and he maintains that, even though living beings and inert matter are dependent upon Brahman, such dependence differentiates them from Him and makes them discrete entities (tattvas). Thus, reality in Madhva’s system consists of three basic elements: God, the souls (jivasi), and insentient matter (jada).

Madhva’s pluralistic ontology is founded on his realist epistemology, which in turn affects his Vedic hermeneutics. He argues that God and the human soul are separate because our daily experience of separateness from God and of plurality in general is presented to us as an undeniable fact, fundamental to our knowledge of all things. Madhva’s emphasis on the validity of experience as a means of knowledge is intended to refute the nondualist position that the differences we experience in daily life are ultimately a shared illusion with the ambiguous ontological status of being neither real nor unreal. In Madhva’s view, Advaita’s denial of the innate validity of knowledge acquired through sense perception completely undermines our ability to know anything since we must always question the content of our knowledge. This questioning would encompass our knowledge of the sacred canon, which is accessible to us only through our ability to perceive it and to draw inferences from it. Madhva argues that perception and inference must be innately valid and the reality they present us with must be actually and ultimately real since such a position is the only one that allows us to know the content of the Vedas. The Vedas alone are responsible for teaching us about the nature of the self and brahman.

This aspect of Madhva’s realist epistemology is important not only because it bolsters Madhva’s claim that the atman and brahman are permanently distinct as revealed to us by experience, but because it means that the sacred texts must be read in consonance with the data we receive from our everyday experience, even though the Vedas present us with knowledge of a supra-sensible realm. Madhva argues that the Vedas cannot teach non-difference between the atman and brahman or a lack of true plurality since this would directly contradict our experience. In Madhva’s view the sacred texts teach pancabheda, the five-fold difference between 1. Visnu and jivas 2. Visnu and jada 3. jiva and jada 4. one jiva and another and 5. one form of jada and another.

Madhva’s belief in the innate difference of one soul from another led to some interesting doctrines in his system. He believed in a hierarchy of jivas, based upon their innate configurations of virtues (gunas) and faults (dosas). For example, Visnu is supreme because He possesses all qualities in their most fulfilled and perfect form. Furthermore, because Madhva believed that souls possess innate characteristics and capacities, he also maintained that they were predestined to achieve certain ends. This perspective put Madhva at odds with traditional Hindu views of the karma theory wherein differences in social and religious status are explained via past moral or immoral acts. For Madhva, each individual being possesses an innate moral propensity and karma is merely the mechanism by which a given soul is propelled towards his or her destiny.

4. Canonical Sources

Madhva’s attempts to locate his controversial views in the canonical Vedanta texts often proved difficult. He is perhaps most famous for his idiosyncratic rendering of the Chandogya Upanisad’s statement tat tvam asi or “you (the atman) are that (brahman).” By carrying over the ‘a’ from the preceding word, Madhva rendered the phrase atat tvam asi or “you are not that.” Some scholars have speculated on “foreign,” particularly Christian, influences on Madhva’s thought but current scholarly consensus maintains that political and social changes in Madhva’s region prompted a new approach to old religious convictions.

Madhva’s Dvaita Vedanta is recognized as one of the three major schools of Vedanta (besides Sankara’s Advaita and Ramanuja’s Visistadvaita Vedanta). It has been further developed by such major figures as Jayatirtha (1356-1388) and Vyasaraya (1478-1589) and is kept alive by a still flourishing community [Madhva sampradaya] in India with its main center at Udipi (Karnataka).

5. References and Further Reading

• Sharma, B. N. K. Philosophy of Sri Madhvacarya. Rev. ed. Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass, 1986.
• Sharma, B. N. K. Madhva’s Teachings in His Own Words. Bombay: Bharatiya Vidya Bhavan, 1961.
• Siauve, Suzanne. La Doctrine de Madhva. Pondicherry: Institut Francais d’Indologie, 1968.

Author Information

Valerie Stoker
Email: valerie.stoker@wright.edu
Wright State University
U. S. A.

Rāmānuja (c. 1017 – c. 1137)

Rāmānuja (ācārya), the eleventh century South Indian philosopher, is the chief proponent of Viśiṣṭādvaita, which is one of the three main forms of the Orthodox Hindu philosophical school, Vedānta. As the prime philosopher of the Viśiṣṭādvaita tradition, Rāmānuja is one of the Indian philosophical tradition’s most important and influential figures. He was the first Indian philosopher to provide a systematic theistic interpretation of the philosophy of the Vedas, and is famous for arguing for the epistemic and soteriological significance of bhakti, or devotion to a personal God. Unlike many of his contemporaries, Rāmānuja defended the reality of a plurality of individual persons, qualities, values and objects while affirming the substantial unity of all. On some accounts, Rāmānuja’s influence on popular Hindu practice is so vast that his system forms the basis for popular Hindu philosophy. His two main philosophical writings (the Śrī Bhāṣya and Vedārthasaṅgraha) are amongst the best examples of rigorous and energetic argumentation in any philosophical tradition, and they are masterpieces of Indian scholastic philosophy.

Table of Contents

1. Rāmānuja’s Life and Works
2. Rāmānuja’s Cosmology and Metaphysics
   1. Background
   2. Negative Philosophical Criticisms of Bhedābheda and Advaita Vedānta
      1. Logical Criticism
      2. Argument from Epistemology
   3. Substantive Theses
      1. Intentionality of Consciousness
      2. Consciousness is a Property of Something
      3. Individuals are Real
   4. Hermeneutic Criticism
      1. Vedas as Doctrinally Unified Corpus
      2. “Tat tvam asi” and Co-ordinate Predication
      3. Brahman and Ātman
3. Rāmānuja’s Theism
4. Rāmānuja’s Soteriology
5. Rāmānuja’s Epistemology
   1. Perception
   2. Scripture
   3. Bhakti
   4. Error
6. Rāmānuja’s Ethics
   1. Substantive Ethics
   2. Foundations of Ethics
7. Interpreting Rāmānuja: the Northern and Southern Schools and the Authenticity of the Gadyas
8. Conclusion: Rāmānuja’s Place in the History of Indian Philosophy
9. References and Further Readings
   1. Primary Sources
   2. b. Secondary Sources on Rāmānuja

1. Rāmānuja’s Life and Works

On traditional accounts, Rāmānuja lived the unusually long life of 120 years (twice the average lifespan at the time), from 1017 to 1137 C.E., though recent scholarship places his life between 1077 to 1157 C.E., with a life of 80 years (Carman p.27). He was born in the Southern, Tamil speaking region of India, in the small township of Śrīperumbūdur on the outskirts of modern day Chennai (Madras) into a family that hailed from a subclass of Brahmins (the Hindu priestly caste) known for their scholarship and learning in the Vedas. His family was likely bilingual, fluent in both the local vernacular (Tamil) and the language of scholarship (Sanskrit). From a young age he is reputed to have displayed a prodigious intellect and liberal attitudes towards caste. At this time he became friendly with a local, saintly Sudra (member of the servile caste) by the name of Kāñcīpurna, whose occupation it was to perform services for the local temple idol of the Hindu deity Vishnu. Rāmānuja admired Kāñcīpurna’s piety and devotion to Vishnu and sought Kāñcīpurna as his guru-much to the horror of Kāñcīpurna who regarded Rāmānuja’s humility before him as an affront to caste propriety.

Shortly after being married in his teenage years, and after his father passed away, Rāmānuja and his family moved to the neighboring city of Kāñcīpuram. There Rāmānuja found his first formal teacher, Yādavaprakāśa, who was an accomplished professor of the form of the Vedānta philosophy that was in vogue at the time-a form of Vedānta that has strong affinities to Śaṅkara’s Absolute Idealistic Monism (Advaita Vedānta) but was also close to the Difference-and-non-difference view (Bhedābheda Vedānta). (“Vedānta” means the ‘end of the Vedas’ and refers to the philosophy expressed in the end portion of the Vedas, also known as the Upaniṣads, and encoded in the cryptic summary by Bādarāyaṇa called the Vedānta Sūtra or Brahma Sūtra. The perennial questions of Vedānta are: what is the nature of Brahman, or the Ultimate, and what is the relationship between the multiplicity of individuals to this Ultimate. Vedānta comprises one of the six orthodox schools of Hindu philosophy.)

At first Yādavaprakāśa was thrilled to receive a talented and intelligent student of the likes of Rāmānuja. But disagreements between the two, on the proper interpretation of the Upaniṣads, soon broke out. Yādavaprakāśa favored an amoral, impersonal, non-theistic interpretation of the Upaniṣads. Rāmānuja, in contrast, favored a theistic interpretation of the Upaniṣads that placed a premium on the aesthetic and moral excellences of Brahman. Yādavaprakāśa found Rāmānuja’s skill at offering alternative interpretations threatening both to his authority and the popularity of his philosophy. He thus hatched a plan, with some of his other students, to murder Rāmānuja while on a pilgrimage. Rāmānuja however got word of the plan from his classmate and cousin (Govinda) and escaped from the pilgrimage with his life. Rāmānuja (surprisingly) did not make public his knowledge of the failed assassination attempt and resumed classes with Yādavaprakāśa when he returned to Kāñcīpuram. Yādavaprakāśa for his part did not reveal his complicity in the plot to take Rāmānuja’s life, and feigned happiness at continuing to be his teacher. Not too long afterwards, however, Yādavaprakāśa ordered Rāmānuja to leave his school, after a final disagreement on the interpretation of scripture occurred.

Without a teacher, Rāmānuja returned dejected to his childhood mentor, Kāñcīpurna, who assured him that a teacher would come his way. For the time being, Kāñcīpurna instructed Rāmānuja to help him in his manual service to the temple idol of Vishnu.

At the same time Yamuna, the spiritual head of the fledgling Tamil Vaiṣṇava (Vishnu worshiping) community, was near the end of his life and in search of a successor. This community, known as the Śrī Vaiṣṇava Sampradāya, was formed around the memory of the Four Thousand Tamil Verses (Nālāyira Divya Prabhandam) of twelve Tamil Vaiṣṇava saints (Āḻvārs), renowned for their devotional poetry on Vishnu. While it had a modest popular base, it lacked a formal and legitimizing articulation in the Sanskrit academic community. Though a competent and accomplished philosopher in his own right who authored the impressive Siddhi Trayam, Yamuna came into the fold too late in his life to fully articulate the philosophy of Śrī Vaiṣṇavas to the pan-Indian academic community. He thus held out the hope that Rāmānuja would, amongst other things, take up the task of articulating the philosophical ethos of the tradition that had been entrusted to him, in the form of a formal, Sanskrit commentary on the Brahma Sūtra (the cryptic summary of the philosophical purport of the Upaniṣads). Upon finding out that Rāmānuja had been freed from ties to Yādavaprakāśa, and had returned to the company of Kāñcīpurna (himself a member of Yamuna’s Śrī Vaiṣṇava community) Yamuna was overjoyed and sent word to Rāmānuja to come and take up the post as his successor. Yamuna however died just before Rāmānuja could reach him, and once again Rāmānuja found himself without the teacher he had been searching for.

After Rāmānuja had gained his composure, he made his way over to the crowd centered on Yamuna’s new corpse. He noted that three fingers of Yamuna’s were curled. Yamuna’s senior disciples explained to Rāmānuja that they likely represented three wishes of Yamuna, one of which being that a commentary on the Brahma Sūtra should be written. When Rāmānuja pledged to try to fulfill those wishes, the fingers uncurled. The crowd took this as a sign that Rāmānuja was the heir apparent of Yamuna. Rāmānuja was however vexed at the local temple idol of Vishnu for not even allowing him a brief meeting with Yamuna, and would not formally join the community for nearly a year.

When Rāmānuja did decide to formally join the Śrī Vaiṣṇava fold, Yamuna’s senior disciple, Mahāpūrṇa, supervised his initiation. For a matter of six months, Rāmānuja had found himself the teacher he was looking for in the form of Mahāpūrṇa. Under Mahāpūrṇa, Rāmānuja learned the verses of the Tamil Vaiṣṇava saints. However, his learning under Mahāpūrṇa came to an abrupt end when Rāmānuja’s wife picked a fight with Mahāpūrṇa’s wife, on the premise that the latter was a member of a lower Brahmanic subcaste. Upon hearing this, the hurt Mahāpūrṇa and his wife departed from Rāmānuja’s company without notice. Rāmānuja, once again lost his teacher. But this was not the first time that Rāmānuja’s wife had interfered with his spiritual development.

At an earlier point, Rāmānuja had invited his childhood mentor, Kāñcīpurna, for a meal. Rāmānuja had hoped to partake of Kāñcīpurna’s leavings as a sacrament. However, Kāñcīpurna arrived early in absence of Rāmānuja. Rāmānuja’s wife fed Kāñcīpurna, sent him off, and ritually purified the dining area, by, amongst other things, discarding Kāñcīpurna’s leftovers.

Having lost the benefits of a teacher twice over as a result of his wife’s caste-pretensions, Rāmānuja was incensed. He thus sent his wife back to her natal home, and promptly became a renounciate (saṃnyāsin). He earned the title “king of ascetics (yatirāja) from the temple deity of Vishnu speaking through Kāñcīpurna at this point.

Rāmānuja’s separation from his wife and his initiation into the order of ascetics marks the beginning of his career as an independent and self-assured philosopher. He traveled around India and participated in public debates with exponents of rival philosophies. Many of the philosophers that Rāmānuja defeated became prominent disciples in his fold. Rāmānuja standardized and reformed temple worship in those Vaiṣṇava temples that he gained control over (often through winning debates with the custodians of the temple). To this day his instructions are the norm of Śrī Vaiṣṇava temple and home worship in India and abroad.

The Śrī Vaiṣṇava tradition is unanimous in holding that Rāmānuja authored nine, and only nine, works: all in Sanskrit. While Rāmānuja is reported by the writings of his disciples to have lectured in Tamil on the verses of the Tamil Vaiṣṇava saints, he left no writings on their work, and no explicit mention of them in his writings. At first glance, this seems remarkable, given that the Divya Prabhandam is regarded by the Śrī Vaiṣṇava tradition, as the Tamil equivalent of the Vedas. However, Rāmānuja’s silence on the Āḻvārs in his Sanskrit writings may have been a result of his aim as philosopher to not preach to the converted, but to articulate his philosophy to the pan-Indian academic community.

Rāmānuja’s first work was likely the Vedārthasaṅgraha (‘Summary of the Meaning of the Vedas’). It sets out Rāmānuja’s philosophy, which is theistic (it affirms a morally perfect, omniscient and omnipotent God) and realistic (it affirms the existence and reality of a plurality of qualities, persons and objects). This work is referred to several times in Rāmānuja’s magnum opus, his commentary on the Brahma Sūtra, the Śrī Bhāṣya (also known as his Brahma Sūtra Bhāṣya). This is the work that Rāmānuja is best known by outside of the Śrī Vaiṣṇava tradition. In addition to this large commentary on the Brahma Sūtra, Rāmānuja apparently wrote two more shorter commentaries: Vedāntapīda, and Vedāntasāra. Aside from the Vedārthasaṅgraha and Śrī Bhāṣya, Rāmānuja’s most important philosophic work is a commentary on the Bhagavad Gītā (Bhagavad Gītā Bhāṣya). In addition to these philosophic works, Rāmānuja is held by tradition to have written three prose hymns called collectively the Gadya Traya, which include the Śaraṇāgati Gadya, Śrīraṅga Gadya and the Vaikunṭḥa Gadya). The Śaraṇāgati Gadya is a dialogue between Rāmānuja and the Hindu deities Śrī (Lakṣmī) and Nārāyaṇa (Vishnu) (which jointly comprise God, or Brahman, for Rāmānuja) in which Rāmānuja surrenders himself before God and petitions Vishnu, through Lakṣmī, for his Grace. Vishnu and Lakṣmī, for their part, respond favorably to Rāmānuja’s act of surrender. The Śrīraṅga Gadya is a prayer of surrender to the feet of Ranganatha. (This is Vishnu in his repose on the many headed serpent Ādi Śeṣa -‘ancient servant,’ ‘ancient residue,’ or ‘primeval matter’- on the milk ocean.) The Vaikunṭḥa Gadya describes in great detail the eternal realm of Vishnu, called Vaikunṭḥa, on which one should meditate in order to gain liberation. Finally Rāmānuja is held to have authored a manual of daily worship called the Nityagrantha.

The authenticity of all but the three large works attributed to Rāmānuja – Śrī Bhāṣya, Vedārthasaṅgraha and the Bhagavad Gītā Bhāṣya – have come into question in recent times. The argument against the authenticity of these texts appears to be a minority position amongst scholars. With respect to the two smaller commentaries on the Brahma Sūtra, it has been argued that they must be inauthentic, because it seems unlikely that Rāmānuja would himself have bothered to take the time to abridge his larger commentary, the Śrī Bhāṣya (cf. Buitenen p.32). With respect to the short religious works attributed to Rāmānuja, it has been argued that they present doctrines that go beyond those that are found in his major commentaries (cf. Lester p.279).

2. Rāmānuja’s Cosmology and Metaphysics

a. Background

Subsequent tradition has applied the label “Viśiṣṭādvaita” to the philosophy of Rāmānuja. It is meant to contrast his philosophy from leading competing views, such as Advaita (Non-Dualist), Bhedābheda (Difference-and-non-difference) and Dvaita (Dualist) Vedānta. The term “Viśiṣṭādvaita” is often translated as ‘Qualified Non-Dualism.’ An alternative, and more informative, translation is “Non-duality of the qualified whole,” or perhaps ‘Non-duality with qualifications.” The label attempts to mark out Rāmānuja’s effort to affirm the unity of the many, without giving up on the reality of distinct persons, qualities, universals, or aesthetic and moral values.

Where all versions of Vedānta intersect is in their effort to provide a consistent and defendable interpretation of the Brahma Sūtra, on philosophical and hermeneutic grounds. Given the common textual bases, there are certain doctrinal invariances amongst the various sub-schools of Vedānta.

In accordance with the Upaniṣads, the various schools of Vedānta hold that there is an ultimate entity, called Brahman, which also is referred to by scripture as “Ātman” (“Self”). The Vedānta schools recognize, in accordance with the Upaniṣads, that Brahman plays a key role in the organization of the universe. Attainment of Brahman by an individual constitutes its highest good: soteriological liberation or moḳsa.

The chief areas of disagreement amongst the various schools of Vedānta are on the nature and ontological status of individual selves, objects of cognition and Brahman, as well as the relevance and importance of ethics or duty (dharma) to the good life.

Rāmānuja’s foils in the articulation of his philosophy are two forms of Vedānta that were not clearly distinguished during his day: these are the Bhedābheda view, and the Advaita philosophy. Both these views take a similar stance on the relationship of an individual’s subjectivity and Brahman: on both accounts, the conscious principle of the individual is of a piece with Brahman. In the case of Advaita Vedānta, the consciousness of an individual is regarded as numerically identical with the consciousness of Brahman. On this view, the psychological ego or sense of individuality is something distinct from consciousness: it is its object. The Bhedābheda view similarly asserts the numerical identity of an individual’s consciousness and Brahman, but it emphasizes that this identity is counteracted by a separating off, or differentiating effort, on the part of Brahman to compartmentalize itself and mysteriously constitute the world of plurality and difference. On this view, the individual ego is constituted by Brahman. According to the versions of Bhedābheda and Advaita that Rāmānuja was acquainted with, mere knowledge of one’s identity with Brahman is sufficient to bring about liberation; works, such as ritual and moral obligations, can at best play a preparatory role in bringing an individual to the state of being desirous for liberation, but they have no intrinsic value. Corollaries of these views are the position that consciousness, and not plurality, is metaphysically fundamental; that consciousness does not require objects for its existence; that belief in plurality consists in the uncritical acceptance of ordinary experience; and that dialectical reasoning can yield substantive knowledge with practical import. On many fronts (on the reality of universals, particulars, and moral values) both the Bhedābheda Advaita schools are classic forms of anti-realism.

Students of Rāmānuja’s thought may wish to know whom Rāmānuja is arguing against. In all likely hood, it is his former teacher, Yādavaprakāśa. However, Rāmānuja does not attribute the Advaita or Bhedābheda views to any particular philosopher. Rather, these views are voiced by the opponent, or the ubiquitous pūrvapakṣin , everywhere in Indian philosophy, expressing the views to be criticized.

Rāmānuja’s arguments that he presents against his opponent are of roughly three varieties. Some are negative, and focus on philosophical problems of the opponent’s view. Some are positive, and concern arguing for theses that Rāmānuja wishes to defend. And some arguments are hermeneutic. This last category of arguments combines criticism and positive philosophical argument, but it centers on the proper interpretation of the Vedas.

b. Negative Philosophical Criticisms of Bhedābheda and Advaita Vedānta

i. Logical Criticism

Rāmānuja criticizes many of the arguments of the Bhedābheda and Advaita views on logical grounds. These schools employed dialectical arguments that conclude on the basis of logical puzzles that arise in accounting for distinctions and difference in perception that difference (which includes the idea of a distinct quality) is an unintelligible notion. From such considerations, these philosophers would typically conclude that only undifferentiated consciousness is the real (Brahman). Rāmānuja at many points in the Śrī Bhāṣya and the Vedārthasaṅgraha attempts to argue against such views by an argument ad absurdum. Particularly, Rāmānuja argues that the arguments presented by the Bhedābheda and Advaita Vedāntins lead to intolerable contradictions and further conclusions that go against common sense. At one point he suggests that those who would make such arguments are “no better than a man who would claim that his own mother never had any children” (Śrī Bhāṣya, I.i.1. “Great Siddhānta” p.44).

ii. Argument from Epistemology

Rāmānuja argues that the epistemic considerations that his opponents adduce for their positions undercut their own views. The philosophers that Rāmānuja takes aim at argue that all means of cognition involve error. Rāmānuja argues that if this is so, it follows that we could never know that all cognition involves error, for such putative knowledge would itself involve an erroneous cognition, and hence not qualify as genuine knowledge. If Rāmānuja’s opponents view is correct, then it follows that some cognitions are not erroneous. But this is exactly what the disputed conclusion rules out (Śrī Bhāṣya, I.i.1. “Great Siddhānta” pp.74-78).

c. Substantive Theses

i. Intentionality of Consciousness

While the previous two strategies that Rāmānuja employs in his criticism of the Bhedābheda and Advaita views are largely negative, and involve criticizing these views on formal grounds, Rāmānuja also defends philosophical theses that these two schools rule out. The most important of these theses is the view that consciousness is always consciousness of some object distinguished by a characteristic (cf. Śrī Bhāṣya, I.i.1. “Great Siddhānta” p.53 and “Great Pūrvapakṣa” p.32). This is the doctrine known as “dharmabhūtajñāna” in the Viśiṣṭādvaita tradition (Śrīnivāsadāsa VII.2). It implies the view that all epistemic states, be it consciousness or perception, are intentional or object oriented. If it is the case that even consciousness requires an object for its existence, it follows that there can be no such thing as pure consciousness apart from difference (such as qualities, properties and objects of consciousness). Thus, on this account, if consciousness exists, it follows that difference and plurality does as well. With this one thesis, and against the backdrop of Vedāntic idealism, Rāmānuja is able to generate one limb of his organismic cosmology.

ii. Consciousness is a Property of Something

Another important substantive philosophical thesis that Rāmānuja defends is that consciousness is itself a property. To modern readers, this may seem to be a trivial point. However, it is central to the project of Rāmānuja’s opponents that Brahman is the only reality, and it is a reality devoid of distinctions or qualities. Rāmānuja’s opponents are happy to affirm that certain things can be said of Brahman, for instance, that it is (as affirmed in the Taittirīya Upaniṣad II.i.1.) truth (satyam) knowledge (jñānam) and infinite (anantam). However, they take the stand that these are not properties of Brahman, but the very being of Brahman (Śrī Bhāṣya, I.i.1. “Great Pūrvapakṣa” p.29). Rāmānuja, in contrast, defends the view that such attributions bring attention to the reality of Brahman‘s qualities (cf. Śrī Bhāṣya, I.i.1. “Great Pūrvapakṣa” p.28).

iii. Individuals are Real

A third and important substantive thesis that Rāmānuja defends is the reality of the individual. According to Advaita Vedānta (and the Bhedābheda view to a lesser extent), the individual person, in contradistinction to other persons, is an illusion (māyā) that comes about by nescience (avidya). Rāmānuja argues that the very idea that something can be ignorant presumes that there is an individual capable of being ignorant. For all Vedāntins affirm that Brahman is of the nature of consciousness and knowledge. Hence, to say that Brahman is ignorant is absurd. If anything is subject to ignorance, it must be an individual other than Brahman. However, if this is so, then ignorance cannot be brought into explain the existence of individuals, for it presumes the existence of an individual capable of being ignorant. Rāmānuja’s positive view is thus that there are, indeed, distinct individuals, many who are under the spell of ignorance. However, their individuality is ontologically and logically prior to their ignorance (Śrī Bhāṣya, I.i.1. “Great Siddhānta” p.103)

d. Hermeneutic Criticism

All Vedānta philosophies must turn to the Vedas, and particularly the Upaniṣads, for scriptural grounding. Hence, in criticizing his fellow Vedāntins, Rāmānuja makes use of arguments that concern the proper interpretation of scripture.

i. Vedas as Doctrinally Unified Corpus

According to Rāmānuja, his opponents have failed to arrive at an interpretation of the Vedas based on all Vedic texts. Rather, they emphasize some passages that support a monistic interpretation, and ignore those passages that either presume or emphasize plurality. Rāmānuja notes that his opponents hold to the view that those Vedic texts that come later in the corpus are to be emphasized (the fact that they come later is presumed, on this account, to show that they contain the more advanced and esoteric teachings) (Śrī Bhāṣya, I.i.1. “Great Pūrvapakṣa” p.27). These, more than other portions of the Vedas, emphasize the oneness of reality with Brahman. Rāmānuja argues that even these portions of the Vedas presume and affirm plurality. Even if it were not the case that these portions of the Vedas mentioned plurality, we would have to take all the Vedas on par for Rāmānuja. According to Rāmānuja, one cannot attempt to give interpretations of isolated portions of the Vedas. Rather, one must take the Vedas as one unified corpus, aiming at the expression of a single doctrine (cf. Śrī Bhāṣya pp.92-3, I.i.1. “Great Siddhānta“). Hence, any tenable interpretation of the philosophy of the Vedas must not only affirm the reality of plurality, but also the importance of ritual and moral obligations (dharma), for these are spoken about at length in the earlier portions of the Vedas.

ii. “Tat tvam asi” and Co-ordinate Predication

Even if the Vedic corpus as a whole is taken to present a single doctrine, Rāmānuja is still left with the task of accounting for how the seemingly monistic portions of the Upaniṣads are consistent with the reality of a plurality of distinct individuals. To overcome this hermeneutic hurdle, Rāmānuja introduces the doctrine of sāmānādhikaraṇya , sometimes translated as “co-ordinate predication” or “the principle of grammatical coordination” but literally meaning ‘several things in a common substrate.’ The etymology of the word suggests an ontological doctrine. However, Rāmānuja means to employ it as a semantic doctrine. According to Rāmānuja, “The experts on such matters define it thus: `The signification of an identical entity by several terms [śabda] which are applied to that entity on different grounds is co-ordinate predication” (Vedārthasaṅgraha §24).

In both the Śrī Bhāṣya and the Vedārthasaṅgraha, Rāmānuja draws a distinction between the object denoted by a term, and the quality that it can be identified in connection with. The possibility of using various terms with the same denotation but with different qualitative content is what Rāmānuja calls “co-ordinate predication.”

The doctrine that Rāmānuja advances under the heading of co-ordinate predication strikingly anticipates the Fregean distinction between sense and reference. In the writings of Rāmānuja, the doctrine is used to interpret monistic passages of the Vedas in a manner that affirms both the unity of the thing designated, via the coreferentiality of the various terms, while affirming that the various terms bring to the sentence an emphasis on distinct properties of the unitary thing so identified. With respect to the famous formula “that thou art” (tat tvam asi) from the Chandyoga Upaniṣad (which Advaitins quote as support for the absolute identity of the individual’s self with Brahman), Rāmānuja understands the indexicals “that” and “thou” as signifying an underlying unity, while containing distinct qualitative content. Hence, “that” in this context, brings to fore the quality of the underlying substantial unity of all individuals in Brahman, while “thou” emphasize that we, as individuals, are qualities or distinctions in this underlying unity (Śrī Bhāṣya, I.i.1. “Great Siddhānta” pp.129-39).

iii. Brahman and Ātman

Even if the doctrine of co-ordinate predication is granted, there is yet another hermeneutic hurdle for Rāmānuja to contend with: this is the Upaniṣadic equation of Brahman (the Ultimate) with Ātman (or Self). If the Ultimate and the Self are one, then it would seem that there is no room for the existence of a plurality of individual persons. The problem might be solved by denying that “Ātman” means self, but this would be to stipulate a meaning for the word “Ātman” that it does not have in Sanskrit or Vedic. Rāmānuja’s solution to this problem is the cosmological doctrine of śarīra and śarīrī (body and soul), or śeṣa and śeṣin (dependant and dependant upon). According to Rāmānuja, Brahman is the Self of all. However, this is not because our individual personhood is identical with the personhood of Brahman, but because we, along with all individuals, constitute modes or qualities of the body of Brahman. Thus, Brahman stands to all others as the soul or mind stands to its body. The metaphysical model that Rāmānuja thus argues for is at once cosmological in nature, and organic. All individuals are Brahman by virtue of constituting its body, but all individuals retain an identity in contradistinction to other parts of Brahman, particularly the soul of Brahman.

In accordance with much of the monism of Upaniṣadic passages, Rāmānuja maintains that there is a way in which the individual self (jīva, or jīvātman) is identical with the Ultimate Self (Ātman or Paramātman). This is in our natures. According to Rāmānuja, each jīva shares with Brahman an essential nature of being a knower. However, due to beginningless past actions (karma) our true nature (as being knowers and dependants upon Brahman) are obscured from us. Moreover, our sharing this nature in no way implies that we have the same relationship to other things (Śrī Bhāṣya, I.i.1. “Great Siddhānta” pp.99-102). In other words, our likeness in one respect with Brahman does not imply that we ourselves are either omnipotent, omniscient or all good.

3. Rāmānuja’s Theism

In contrast to preceding commentators on the Brahma Sūtra, Rāmānuja’s version of Vedānta is explicitly theistic. Brahman as Ātman (the Highest Self of all) is the union of two deities: Vishnu, or Nārāyaṇa, and His Consort Śrī, or Lakṣmī. (In Hinduism, Vishnu is the God who upholds and preserves all things, while Lakṣmī is the Goddess of prosperity.) The unity of both the father (Vishnu) and mother (Lakṣmī) element in Brahman is essential to Rāmānuja. It is a consequence of the view that Brahman is ubhayaliṅgam, or having both sexes: this accounts for Brahman‘s creative potency. According to Rāmānuja, Brahman (considered as the Ātman) is antagonistic to all evil lacks all faults (pāpam, heya, mala or doṣa), and is comprised of innumerable auspicious qualities (kalyāṇaguṇa ): these auspicious qualities are both moral and aesthetic (Vedārthasaṅgraha §§ 2, 6, 9, 19, 92, 112, 147, 161, 163, 198, 234, Śrī Bhāṣya, I.i.1. pp.5, 80, 89, 92, 94, 125, 132, 133, 136, 144, I.i.2. p. 157, I.i.4. p.201, Bhagavad Gītā Bhāṣya I. Intro, IX.34, to name just a few references-Rāmānuja never tires or speaking of God’s excellences.).

The highest Self (Ātman) stands to all other persons as their parent, on Rāmānuja’s account. However, Rāmānuja, like many Vedāntins, does not subscribe to the Medieval Christian doctrine of creation ex nihilo: Brahman does not create individual persons, or basic, non-relational qualities for that matter, for these are eternal features of its Body. Brahman does engage in a form of creation, which consists in granting individual persons the fruits of their desires (whatever they are). The result of this dispensation is the organization of the elements comprising Brahman‘s body into the cosmos (Śrī Bhāṣya, I.i.1. “Great Siddhānta” p.124)

4. Rāmānuja’s Soteriology

On Rāmānuja’s account, our greatest good consists of being ever aware of our true nature (as modes of Brahman) and of being aware of the nature of Brahman. When all impediments to this awareness are removed, the individual attains moḳsa (liberation). Knowledge of Brahman consists in liberation, for Rāmānuja, mainly because of the character of Brahman. He writes:

Entities other than Brahman can be objects of such cognitions of the nature of joy only to a finite extent and for limited duration. But Brahman is such that cognizing of him is an infinite and abiding joy. It is for this reason that the śruti [scripture] says, `Brahman is bliss’ (Taittirīya Upaniṣad II.6.) Since the form of cognition as joy is determined by its object, Brahman itself is joy. (Vedārthasaṅgraha §241)

Rāmānuja is explicit in holding that theoretical knowledge of Brahman‘s nature will not suffice to procure liberation (Śrī Bhāṣya, I.i.1. “Small Siddhānta” pp.13-14). Our embodied state places psychological constraints upon us that must be nullified. The remedy to be employed, for Rāmānuja, is what he calls, after the Bhagavad Gītā, bhakti yoga, or the discipline of devotion or worship. This type of yoga is comprised of two essential elements: (a) an attendance to one’s duties with a deontological sense that they are the things that ought to be done for their own sake, and not for their consequences (also known as karma yoga), and (b) the constant worship of Brahman, particularly in the form of offering all of the fruits of one’s labor to Brahman. These features of bhakti yoga serve two complimentary purposes. First, they counteract past undesirable actions (karmas) whose residual effects impede a full appreciation of reality. Secondly, they inculcate subservience before Brahman. This is valuable for Rāmānuja, for service to God, on his account, is constitutive of an unbroken appreciation of Brahman‘s nature.

5. Rāmānuja’s Epistemology

Epistemic concerns figure centrally in Rāmānuja’s arguments, and his diagnosis of the state of bondage (saṃsāra ), or non-liberation. Like many Indian philosophers, Rāmānuja holds that liberation comes about by the cessation of nescience (Śrī Bhāṣya, I.i.1. “Small Siddhānta” p.12). However, unlike many of his contemporaries, Rāmānuja does not believe that reason is an independent means of knowledge, capable of dispelling ignorance.

a. Perception

Rāmānuja holds a position that is similar to naïve empiricism. According to naïve empiricism, the only knowledge that one can have is knowledge that one has gained by one’s own experience. Rāmānuja’s view is like naïve empiricism, in so far as his intentional account of the nature of all epistemic states (dharmabhūtajñāna) leads him to the view that all genuine or first-rate knowledge (jñāna) consists in a perceptual relationship between a knower and an object of knowledge-knowledge de re-and not between a believer and a sentence or proposition-knowledge de dicto. Unlike some proponents of naïve empiricism, Rāmānuja does not think that it suffices to intermittently have an acquaintance with objects of knowledge. Knowledge (jñāna) only occurs when there is direct perception of an object. Unlike proper empiricists, Rāmānuja does not restrict knowledge to that which can be gathered from the senses. The individual self (jīva) on Rāmānuja’s account is also capable of having a direct vision of transcendent entities, like Brahman. Yet, the character of the epistemic state in which one is acquainted with Brahman is a type of perception for Rāmānuja.

b. Scripture

Because of Rāmānuja’s perceptual conception of knowledge, he does not regard acquaintance with scripture (śruti) as anything more than knowledge of the sentence meaning of scripture (cf. Śrī Bhāṣya, I.i.1. “Small Siddhānta” pp.13-14). Yet, like many of his fellow Vedāntins, Rāmānuja regards scripture (śruti) as a pramāṇa, or a means of knowledge. śruti, or the revealed literature, consists of a very specific corpus of texts: the Vedas. (If Rāmānuja believed that the Divya Prabhandam authored by the Tamil Vaiṣṇava saints is the Tamil equivalent of the Vedas, then he would have held these to also be within the purview of śruti). Scripture is an important source of knowledge, for Rāmānuja, for it is the only place that we can learn of our moral obligations (dharma) and what our liberation consists in (moḳsa). On the basis of the validity of scripture, several texts gain a derivative authority. These texts are smṛti (remembered) texts, which include the law books (dharmaśāstras) of eminent figures, and seemingly sacred texts like the Bhagavad Gītā. On the question of the justification of taking scripture seriously, Rāmānuja holds that none can be given. Scripture is self-justifying. Scripture, for its part, can lead people to have cognitions of independent entities, such as Brahman, after providing them directions to perceive Brahman: without it one would never know what to look for. However, sensuous perception cannot vouch for the veracity of its contents, nor can reason independently provide a rational proof of its veracity. Having followed scripture’s dictates, one will eventually have proof of its validity (Śrī Bhāṣya I.i.4. p.175) (direct perceptual contact with objects such as Brahman). However, prior to embarking on the journey outlined in scripture, it must be taken on faith alone. Thus, on the position of the validity of scripture, Rāmānuja is a fideist (see Śrī Bhāṣya I.i.3. for Rāmānuja’s classic criticism of natural theology pp.162-74). (Some critics are apt to think that Rāmānuja is correct on the ungroundability of the validity of scripture on either sensuous perception or reason, but that this impossibility makes Rāmānuja’s whole philosophy implausible.)

While according scripture great weight, Rāmānuja shows his preference for common sense by tempering his interpretations of scripture in light of ordinary, sensuous experience. Contrary to the dialectically minded philosophers of his day, Rāmānuja presumes in his defense of Viśiṣṭādvaita in the Śrī Bhāṣya (I.i.1.) that scriptural interpretation must accord with ordinary experience.

c. Bhakti

Rāmānuja’s unique contribution to Indian epistemology is the view that bhakti, or devotion, is itself an epistemic state. We have noted that, for Rāmānuja, knowledge of Brahman consists in directly perceiving it. When bhakti takes firm root in an individual, it turns into parabhakti, which is the highest order of bhakti. In all cases, however, bhakti is a direct awareness of Brahman‘s nature, and thus constitutes a type of knowledge (jñāna) (Vedārthasaṅgraha §238). The perceptual character of bhakti is sometimes obscured by Rāmānuja’s synonyms for this state. He sometimes calls it meditation or worship (upāsana). However, he also insists that it is a kind of seeing, which has the character of direct perception (pratyakṣatā or sākṣātkāra) (cf. Śrī Bhāṣya, I.i.1. “Small Pūrvapakṣa” pp.15-7).

d. Error

Rāmānuja’s object oriented account of knowledge has the problem of accounting for error. If knowledge corresponds to objects, what do false beliefs correspond to: mental objects? His response anticipates Bertrand Russell’s account of error in On Denoting, which does away with ersatz objects in the explanation of error. According to Rāmānuja, erroneous experiences, like dream states, are real, and they can be genuine objects of knowledge (as in the statement ‘I dreamt last night’ or ‘I am dreaming’). However, the objects that the experience claims to be about are absent in false cognitions. This absence of the proper objects of knowledge explains the erroneousness of beliefs in them (Śrī Bhāṣya I.i.1. “Great Siddhānta” p.78). Thus, on Rāmānuja’s account, mistaking mother of pearl for a piece of silver does not consist in mistakenly seeing something silver in color, but in the mistaken cognition that the object perceived is a piece of silver.

6. Rāmānuja’s Ethics

Rāmānuja’s ethics divides into his views on substantive matters, and metaethical issues.

a. Substantive Ethics

Rāmānuja’s substantive ethics in turn has two sources. Like other orthodox Hindu thinkers, Rāmānuja holds that the primary source of moral knowledge is the Vedas. This is particularly true of the earlier portion of the Vedas, which sets forth prescribed and optional works (karmas) that constitute dharma. The importance of dharma, derived from the Vedas, is stressed in all three of Rāmānuja’s major works. Like other orthodox Hindu thinkers, Rāmānuja also holds that the venerable tradition, or smṛti literature, supplements the Vedic texts’ account of dharma. The most important of the smṛti texts, for Rāmānuja, is the Bhagavad Gītā.

The Gītā emphasizes the importance of adopting a deontological attitude (concern for duty for duty’s sake and not for its consequences) in order to perfect the execution of prescribed duties, particular to one’s place in society. But the Gītā also emphasizes the importance of certain virtues. The Gītā praises being a friend (mitra) and showing compassion (karuṇā) to all creatures (Bhagavad Gītā XII.13), and enumerates ahimsa, or non-injury, as one of the virtues essential to having jñāna, or gnosis (Bhagavad Gītā XIII.7-11).

On what is to be done when the requirements of virtues conflict with prescribed duties, Rāmānuja is uncompromising. For Rāmānuja, dharma, as set forth in the Vedas, is inviolable. This puts Rāmānuja in the awkward position of having to defend the propriety of animal sacrifices, sanctioned and prescribed in the earlier portion of the Vedas. Śrī Vaiṣṇava Brahmins, as a rule, are vegetarians. Rāmānuja was, in all likelihood, himself a vegetarian. However, his general inclination to positively endorse the Bhagavad Gītā‘s disavowal of animal cruelty did not stop him from affirming the propriety of animal sacrifices. In this respect, Rāmānuja agrees with his Advaitin predecessor, Śaṅkara, who held that while violence in general is evil, ritual slaughter is not any ordinary act of violence: because it is sanctioned by the Vedas, it cannot be evil (Śaṅkara, Brahma Sūtra Bhāṣya, III.i.25). Rāmānuja however goes further and argues that ritual slaughter is not only not evil; it is also not really a form of violence. Rather, it is a healing act like a physician’s procedure, which causes temporary pain but is ultimately to the benefit of the patient. The sacrificed animal, on Rāmānuja’s account, is more than compensated in the next life for being ritually slaughtered (Śrī Bhāṣya, III.i.25. pp.599-600).

b. Foundations of Ethics

Rāmānuja’s metaethical comments concern the ground and validity of morality. Rāmānuja seems to have always presumed that morality is intrinsically valuable. The intrinsic merit of God Himself, on Rāmānuja’s account, is tied to His moral excellences. Given that God has nothing to gain by being moral, the value of morality, at least in God’s case, cannot be instrumental. However, for all other creatures, morality, or dharma, has an instrumental value: it helps counteract consequences of past karmas. Importantly, it is also the easy way to propitiate God. Rāmānuja notes that, in theory, it is possible to achieve liberation through mental efforts alone. However, this is only a theoretical possibility, and is in reality impossible for creatures like us. jñāna yoga, or mental disciplines geared towards achieving liberation by solely meditating upon the Self (and not availing oneself of ancillary aids, like attendance to one’s duties) is difficult and likely to lead to error. Karma yoga, or attendance to one’s duties, on the other hand, is easy for our duties are those obligations suited to our capacities and nature (Rāmānuja Gītā Bhāṣya, XVIII.47 p.583). Morality, on Rāmānuja’s account, has both intrinsic and instrumental value. This account of the instrumental value of our obligations also contains, within it, the seeds of an account of the validity of our obligations: our obligations are those appropriate acts that are suited to us to perform. Thus, morality is not simply a law imposed from outside, on Rāmānuja’s account, but the best mode of action, given our personal natures. However, because of our context, we are unable to determine what is best for us, independently of scripture. Hence, our reliance on scripture to tell us our duties leads to the appearance that dharma is a law imposed on us from outside.

Dharma (duty or morality) is of the utmost importance for Rāmānuja. It thus might seem ironic that the Bhagavad Gītā itself advises us to give up our dharmas. At the very end of the work, after the importance and benefits of living the virtuous life are extolled, Krishna (the incarnation of Vishnu delivering a sermon in the Bhagavad Gītā) advises us to ‘give up all dharmas’ and seek refuge in Him alone (Bhagavad Gītā XVIII.66). Rāmānuja offers two interpretations of this verse: (1) it can be taken as implying that we are to abandon the sense of agency that is incompatible with our cosmological dependence upon God, or (2), it can be taken as implying that we ought to give up recourse to expiatory rituals (sometime called “dharmas“) to nullify the effects of past actions. Neither interpretation allows for abandoning our prescribed obligations (Rāmānuja, Bhagavad Gītā Bhāṣya XVIII.66, p.599). Rāmānuja’s views contrast sharply with the views of the Advaita Vedāntin Śaṅkara, who argues that morality (dharma) for the seeker of liberation (moḳsa) is an evil, for it ensnares a person in things of the world (Śaṅkara, Bhagavad Gītā Bhāṣya, IV:21 pp.202-203).

7. Interpreting Rāmānuja: the Northern and Southern Schools and the Authenticity of the Gadyas

Within two centuries after Rāmānuja, the Śrī Vaiṣṇava tradition split into two separate sub-traditions. Both schools claim to have the authority of Rāmānuja in support of their views. These traditions are the Northern or Vaḍagalai school, and the Southern or Tengalai school. The respective founding figures of these schools are Vedānta Deśika and Manavālamāmuni, two of many eminent Śrī Vaiṣṇava scholars to follow Rāmānuja. One manner in which the Northern and Southern schools differ is with respect to the importance that the Vedas are to play in the devotees life: the Northern school holds that Vedic observances are essential to proper Śrī Vaiṣṇava practices, while the Southern school emphasises the importance of emulating the examples of the twelve Āḻvārs. Most importantly, the two schools differ on the relationship between divine grace and individual effort. Both schools agree that Grace is necessary for liberation, but they disagree as to the conditions under which Grace is dispensed. According to the Northern school, Grace is conditional on the effort of the individual. Liberation, on this view, is a cooperative effort between God and the aspirant. According to the Southern school, Grace is dispensed freely. Liberation, on this view, is the sole responsibility of God. (On some accounts, the two schools can also be defined with respect to eighteen points of difference. See Govindācārya for one of the few but regrettably unbalanced accounts of this controversy).

Both schools agree that the intercession of Grace is tied to the devotee performing the spiritual act of śaraṇāgati or prapatti-surrender before God. The act of prapatti, or the formal surrender to God, with the understanding that one has no other refuge, is central to Śrī Vaiṣṇava cultic life. However, Northern and Southern schools differ with respect to what is to follow. For the Southern school, a one-time act of prapatti is sufficient. Subsequent lapses in devotion or attitude do not alter God’s disposition to save the individual. However, for the Northern school, lapses on the part of the devotee require a fresh commitment on the part of the individual to surrender before God, in addition to constant effort on the part of the individual to attend to their moral duties in the spirit of bhakti yoga.

The controversy between the two schools could be circumvented if it could be shown that the very doctrine of śaraṇāgati or prapatti is foreign to the thought of Rāmānuja. This is what some recent scholars have attempted to show. Robert C. Lester, following the arguments of the Vaḍagalai Śrī Vaiṣṇava scholar, Agnihothram Rāmānuja Thatachariar of Kumbakonam, argues that the doctrine of śaraṇāgati or prapatti, at the heart of latter day Śrī Vaiṣṇava controversy, is only found in the Śaraṇāgati Gadya and the Śrīraṅga Gadya, and are absent from Rāmānuja’s main philosophic works. On this basis, Lester argues that the Gadyas (specifically the Śaraṇāgati Gadya and Śrīraṅga Gadya) and the doctrine of śaraṇāgati or prapatti are spurious.

According to this argument, the Gadyas present, for the first time, the view that surrendering to God constitutes a unique means of gaining liberation. And, moreover, Lester argues that this idea is foreign to the arguments that Rāmānuja presents in the Śrī Bhāṣya, the Vedārthasaṅgraha and the Gītā Bhāṣya. These works are unanimous in stressing the role of bhakti as both the beginning and end of liberation.

In defence of the authenticity of the Gadyas, one might argue that the very idea of bhakti contains within it the notion of śaraṇāgati-that to love or be devoted to God is to surrender oneself to God. However, Lester argues that the notion of bhakti promulgated in the three main works of Rāmānuja is distinct from the notion of prapatti or śaraṇāgati in the Gadyas. First, the Śaraṇāgati Gadya makes it clear that the devotee is seeking God, not out of love, but out of desperation, with the request that God grant the devotee bhakti, and the favour of being eternally in His service. Śaraṇāgati or prapatti thus constitutes an act that is logically distinct from what is involved in bhakti, which is the steady remembrance of God, and attendance to one’s duties in a spirit of sacrifice. Secondly, the Gadyas have suggested to many that the act of surrendering to God is sufficient to procure liberation. The critic persuaded by Lester’s view holds that such a view is nowhere to be found in Rāmānuja’s three main works.

In response to Lester’s arguments, one might take a holistic stance: the import of the Gadyas and Rāmānuja’s larger works must be assessed together. This is the stand that has been traditionally adopted by Śrī Vaiṣṇavas of both schools. If this approach is adopted, one is likely to read Rāmānuja’s account of bhakti as implying an implicit understanding of our dependence and helplessness before God (a view shared by both the Northern and Southern schools), and one may also regard the Gadyas as not putting forth the radical notion that the act of surrender is sufficient for liberation (this, however, is what the Southern school appears to be committed to). With respect to Rāmānuja’s main works, there is clear textual evidence that he regarded individuals as impotent, apart from God (cf. Śrī Bhāṣya, II.i.34. pp.478-9). As noted, on Rāmānuja’s account, God’s role as creator is to grant us the fruits of our desires. Without God actually acting on our behalf to simulate a world in which it seems as if we are doers, we would be nothing but isolated persons with many desires, and largely incorrect beliefs, cut off from our peers, with no way to work through our predilections. God’s creative role, on this account, serves the purpose of bridging the gap between ourselves and the rest of reality. On this picture of the human condition, it is quite clear that we as individuals are literally helpless, but for the creative dispensation of God.

Another response to Lester’s argument is to invoke Rāmānuja’s own doctrine of co-ordinate predication, while defending the view that Rāmānuja in his main works holds that prapatti is sufficient for liberation. Rāmānuja in the Vedārthasaṅgraha writes:

The heart of the whole śāstra [body of authoritative texts] is this: The individual selves are essentially of the nature of pure knowledge, devoid of restriction and limitation. They get covered up by nescience in the shape of karma. The consequence is that the scope and breadth of their knowledge is curtailed in accordance with their karma. They get embodied in the multifarious varieties of bodies from [the deity] Brahma down to, the lowest species. Their knowledge is limited in accordance with their specific embodiment. They are deluded into identification with their bodies. In accordance with them they become subject to joys and sorrows, which, in essence constitute what is termed “the river of transmigratory existence” [saṃsāra]. For these individual selves, so lost in saṃsāra, there is no way of emancipation, other than surrender to the supreme Lord [bhagavatprapattimanthrena]. For the purpose of inculcating that sole way of emancipation, the first truth to be taught by the śāstra is that the individual souls are not intrinsically divided into several kinds, like gods, men, etc., and that they are fundamentally alike and are equal in having knowledge as their essential nature. The essential nature of the individual self is such that it is wholly subservient and instrumental to God and therefore God is its inner self. The nature of the supreme Being is unique, on, account of his absolute perfection and absolute antithesis to everything that is evil. God is the ocean of countless, infinitely excellent attributes. The śāstras further assert that all sentient and non sentient entities are sustained and operated by the supreme Being. Therefore, the Supreme is the ultimate self of all. They teach meditation along with its accessory conditions as the means for attaining him. (Vedārthasaṅgraha §99, my italics)

It is noteworthy that while Rāmānuja avails himself of the notion that surrendering to God is the only way to emancipation, he is also clear to emphasise that disciplines such as “meditation” and accessory conditions are essential to attaining liberation. One might argue, thus, that Rāmānuja did hold that prapatti or śaraṇāgati are the “only” way to liberation, but this way is not substantially distinct from the way of bhakti yoga. Rather, “bhakti” and “prapatti” are distinct qualities that qualify one path. On this interpretation, Rāmānuja is assuming that the reader will appreciate the phenomenon of co-ordinate predication, which is the putative semantic phenomenon that Rāmānuja appeals to elsewhere to argue that all individuals are Brahman, while being essentially distinct modes or attributes of Brahman, and not identical to the totality of Brahman. In this way, prapatti and bhakti both denote the same path, but they emphasize different points along the path.

8. Conclusion: Rāmānuja’s Place in the History of Indian Philosophy

Rāmānuja stands in the Indian philosophical tradition as one of its most important figures. He is the first thinker in this tradition to provide a systematic theistic interpretation of the import of the Vedas. His uncompromising stand on the side of common sense and moral realism stands as a striking contrast to stereotyped accounts of Indian philosophical thought as otherworldly and amoral. And while his significance in the history of Indian philosophy may be under appreciated, his greater influence on the character and form of popular Hinduism may also be under-recognized, despite the fact that he is regarded as a saint in many parts of Southern India. According to Karl Potter, “…Rāmānuja’s tradition can be said to represent one of the main arteries through which philosophy reached down to the masses, and it may be that Viśiṣṭādvaita is today the most powerful philosophy in India in terms of numbers of adherents, whether they know themselves by that label or not” (Potter p.253). Whether Potter is correct or not, Rāmānuja is an Indian philosopher who defended the symbiosis of the spiritual, moral and practically earnest life.

9. References and Further Readings

a. Primary Sources

• (Page number references for Rāmānuja’s Śrī Bhāṣya are to the English translation.)
• Rāmānuja (ācārya) (11th Century). Śrī Bhāṣyam (Critical Edition). Melkote: Academy of Sanskrit Research, 1985.
• Rāmānuja (ācārya) (11th Century). Śrī Rāmānuja Gītā Bhāṣya (Bhagavad Gītā Bhāṣya.) Trans. and Ed. Svami Adidevananda. Madras: Śrī Ramakrishna Math, 1991.
• Rāmānuja (ācārya) (11th Century). Śrīmad Bhagavad Rāmānuja Granthamāla. (Complete works.) Ed. Prativadi Bhayankara Annangaracharya. Kancheepuram: available at Granthamala Karyalaya, 1974.
• Rāmānuja (ācārya) (11th Century). Vedānta Sūtras with the Commentary of Rāmānuja (Śrī Bhāṣya). Trans. (English) George Thibaut. Sacred Books of the East. Vol. 48. Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass, 1996.
• Rāmānuja (ācārya) (11th Century).Vedarthasamgraha (Vedārthasaṅgraha). Trans. and Ed. S.S. Ragavachar. Mysore: Sri Ramakrishna Ashrama, 1968.
• Russell, Bertrand (20th Century). “On Denoting.” Mind 14.56 (1905): 479-93.
• Śaṅkara (ācārya) (9th Century). Bhagavadgītā with the Commentary of Śaṅkarācārya (Bhagavad Gītā Bhāṣya). Trans. and Ed. Swami Gambhirananda. Calcutta: Advaita Ashrama, 1991.
• Śaṅkara (ācārya) (9th Century). Brahma Sūtra Bhāṣya. Trans. Swami Gambhirananda. Calcutta: Advaita Ashrama, 1983.
• Śrīnivāsadāsa (17th Century). Yatīndramatadīpikā. Trans. Svami Adidevananda. Madras: Śrī Ramakrishna Math, 1978.
• Yāmuna (ācārya) (11th Century). Śrī Yāmunācārya’s Siddhi Trayam. Trans. K. Srinivasacharya. Ed. R. Ramanujachari: N.p., 1970.

b. Secondary Sources on Rāmānuja

• Buitenen, J. A. B. van. “Introduction.” Trans. J. A. B. van Buitenen. Rāmānuja’s Vedārthasaṅgraha. Ed. J. A. B. van Buitenen. 1st , reprint. ed. Pune: Deccan College Postgraduate and Research Institute, 1956. viii, 316.
• Carman, John B. The Theology of Rāmānuja; an Essay in Interreligious Understanding. Yale Publications in Religion, 18. New Haven: Yale University Press, 1974.
• Govindācārya, A. “The Aṣṭādaśa-Bedas, or the Eighteen Points of Doctrinal Differences Between the Tengalais (Southerners) and the Vaḍagalais (Northerners) of the Viśiṣṭādvaita Vaiṣṇava School, South India.” Journal of the Royal Asiatic Society of Great Britain and Ireland (1910): 1103-12.
• Lester, Robert C. “Rāmānuja and Śrī Vaiṣṇavism : the Concept of Prapatti or Śaraṇāgati.” History of Religion 5.2 (1966): 266-82.
• Potter, Karl H. Presuppositions of India’s Philosophies. Prentice-Hall Philosophy Series. Englewood Cliffs, N.J.: Prentice-Hall, 1963.
• Tapasyananda. Bhakti Schools of Vedānta. Madras: Ramakrishna Math, 1990.

Author Information

Shyam Ranganathan
Email: indian-philosophy@shyam.org
York University
Canada