Leibniz: Law and Justice

Several major themes run through Gottfried Leibniz’s practical philosophy, including the unity of human and divine justice, the degrees of natural right, and the connection between justice, wisdom, and charity (love). This article provides an overview of Leibniz’s practical philosophy, with specific attention given to his moral psychology and natural law theory. The goal is to provide a holistic view of Leibniz’s practical philosophy, drawn from writings in his early, middle, and late periods.

Leibniz is primarily known for his metaphysical idealism and philosophical optimism. According to these views, the fundamental substances in the universe are mind-like entities which are immaterial in nature, and the world which was actualized by God is the best from among an infinite plurality of alternatives. Sometimes forgotten is the fact that Leibniz earned his doctorate in law, practiced law in the court of the archbishop in Mainz, and then spent the next 50 years developing a coherent view of justice which was compatible with, and supported, his philosophical theology. For Leibniz, jurisprudence simply was the relation between human and divine justice. He says as much in the Nova Methodus, writing “what happens in jurisprudence equally happens in theology, because theology is a particular category of jurisprudence taken universally.…”

Leibniz’s theory of law and justice is a distinctive amalgamation of Platonic Rationalism, Roman Law, Stoicism, Christian ethics, the Natural Law tradition, Prudentialism, and Psychological Egoism, drawing on insights from figures such as Hugo Grotius, Samuel Pufendorf, and Thomas Hobbes. Leibniz wove together a moral philosophy and jurisprudence grounded in a proper understanding of moral psychology, happiness, perfection, and love. Although certain details change and become refined over the course of his life, Leibniz held that our understanding of justice has foundation in reason and not in the will of a superior, nor even that of God. Moreover, once we understand the nature of the Good, we can better understand the content of the Natural Law, which then helps humans to flourish and develop just societies.

Historical Context
Foundations of Leibniz’s Jurisprudence
Caritas Sapientis: Justice as the Charity of the Wise
Key Concepts in Leibniz’s Philosophy of Law
Influence and Legacy
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources
2. Secondary Sources

1. Historical Context

The German philosopher, Gottfried Wilhelm Leibniz (1646-1716) was an eclectic philosopher who worked to reconcile competing views into a coherent new system. He worked to bring together Plato with Aristotle, Aristotelian teleology with the physics of the new sciences being developed in the 17^th century, Protestants with Catholics, faith with reason, western philosophy with eastern philosophy, Grotius with Hobbes, and self-interest with justice. Similarly, his moral and jurisprudential thought also drew heavily on a range of sources, most notably Roman law, Stoicism, Natural Law, the Prudential tradition, and Christian Ethics. For the purposes of this article, we need not get lost in the scholarly debates about which philosopher or tradition Leibniz most draws on for his views. Suffice it to say that Leibniz was deeply interested in developing a system which resolved intellectual conflicts, and to do that, he often gestured at competing philosophical theories to try to find common ground.

Leibniz was so conciliatory, in fact, that some critics have argued that Leibniz was not “a thinker of the first rank on law and politics; no basically novel insight can be attributed to him.” (Friedrich, 1972). While it is true that Leibniz was influenced by many different philosophical figures and traditions, it would be a mistake to suggest that all that Leibniz was doing was pulling ideas from different figures without adding anything new of his own. In fact, his mature view that justice should be understood as caritas sapientis—the charity of the wise man, is without historical precedent.

One comment bears mentioning with respect to terminology and translation. Jus and lex are incredibly difficult words to translate because the English equivalents have radically different meanings in different contexts. Jus informs almost every account of moral philosophy in the 17^th century. Sometimes jus can be translated as “just,” “justice,” “right,” and even “law.” Of course, lex is translated as “law” as well. Leibniz almost always uses lex to refer to positive law or divine law, and reserves jus for “(a) general principles of the law, i.e. the science of right (ius, or what is most often called “natural law”; (b) the entire body of laws; (c) an objective sense (that which is just) and (d) a subjective sense, i.e. as a moral quality.” (Johns, 2013, xii). This has led commentators to sometimes translate Leibniz’s jus naturale sometimes as “natural justice” and sometimes as “natural right.” Both translations are not without issues; the former is too broad, and the latter makes it sound, incorrectly, as if Leibniz is a proto-Kantian establishing a deontological theory of justice grounded on rights and duties. In this article, the former translation is preferred, as it is not as egregious an error as the latter. Leibniz tended not to use law when referring to natural law. While Leibniz’s position belongs to the natural law tradition, his emphasis on jus rather than lex means his theory is better understood as a theory of natural justice.

a. Roman Law

Leibniz’s first clear influence on his jurisprudence and moral philosophy was drawn from Roman Law. Roman law was compiled by the Byzantine emperor, Justinian I into the Corpus Juris Civilis in 535 A.D. and included several texts such as the Codex Justinianus, the Digesta, and the Institutiones. These texts were used to train lawyers and judges in Roman courts and went on to influence legal systems through the 17^th and 18th centuries.

Leibniz’s first effort at reforming Roman Law was his Nova Methodus published in Frankfurt in 1667. Although Leibniz was only 21 years old when it was published, the text remained important to him over the course of his life. In fact, as one commentator has remarked, it was “found on his writing desk, face open with revisions in progress, shortly after he died in 1716.” (Johns, 2019, 246). Roman law needed reform, Leibniz thought, because it was largely organized by practices of the time. Instead, Leibniz thought that since jurisprudence was the “science of actions (scientia acitonum), insofar as they are called just and unjust.” (A. VI. i, 300; NM 49-50), and since all sciences are a priori, that is, the truths are discoverable by pure reason alone, Roman Law needed to be reworked into an a priori system. In this sense, Leibniz was explicitly drawing on the methods of Euclid, Descartes, and Hobbes. Law must be based on definitions and logic that are eternally correct, rather than historical and contingent happenstance.

The true nature of law is grounded not on empirical practices of the law, but instead on universal features of human nature. In this sense, Leibniz draws on the insights of figures such as Cicero who writes in De Legibus, “Law is the highest reason, implanted in Nature, which commands what ought to be done and forbids the opposite. This reason, when firmly fixed and fully developed in the human mind, is Law… The origin of justice is to be found in Law, for Law is a natural force.” (Cicero 317) He continues later in the same text, “What of the many deadly, the many pestilential statutes which nations put in force? These no more deserve to be called laws than the rules a band of robbers might pass in their assembly. Law is the distinction between things just and unjust, made in agreement with the most primal and ancient of all things, Nature.” (Cicero 385). In De Re Publica, Cicero writes, “True law is right reason in agreement with nature…It is a sin to try to alter this law, nor is it allowable to attempt to repeal any part of it, and it is impossible to abolish it entirely.” (Cicero 211). In these passages, Cicero explicitly draws attention to the fact that what is natural about natural law is that it is grounded on reason and the natural rational faculties of the human mind. While other philosophers in the natural law tradition sometimes identify different elements of natural law (‘sociability’ in Cicero, for example), Leibniz agrees with Cicero that justice and appropriate conduct is ascertained through reason itself.

From his earliest writings in jurisprudence, Leibniz never wavered in the position that while law is a human phenomenon, it is grounded in that which is natural and universal, namely reason. Reason is the natural part that defines natural law. In the Nova Methodus, Leibniz traces the natural law tradition back to “Plato, Aristotle, Epicurus, Cicero. And in more recent times: Hugo Grotius, Pietro Sforza Pallavicino, Thomas Hobbes, Johann von Felden, and Robert Sharrok.” (A. VI, i, 342; NM 165).

Perhaps the most important principles from Roman Law which Leibniz wanted to preserve and elucidate on a priori grounds were the three degrees of natural right or justice (jus naturale) taken from Justinian’s Institutes: harm no one, give to each his due, and live honorably. These are explained in more detail below.

b. Stoicism

An often-overlooked element of Leibniz’s moral and political philosophy is the influence of the Stoics. While he is sometimes overly critical of their position as being “enemies of reason,” it is clear that Leibniz’s conception of the Good cannot be divorced from their thought. He writes of their view in the Elementa Juris Naturalis, “Ask the Stoics, those airy dreamers, cloud-dwellers, star-gazers, those enemies, professedly of joy, but really of reason. Observe, pry into their acts and movements. You will find that they cannot stir a finger without pointing out the falsehood of their own foolish philosophy. Honor (honestas) itself is nothing but pleasure of the mind. If you listen more carefully to Cicero when he declaims in favor of honor and against pleasure, you will hear him plead magnificently for the beauty of virtue, the deformity of wickedness, the conscience quiet and at peace with itself in the bosom of the joyous mind, the good of uninjured reputation, the triumph of glory. But what is sought in all these things in themselves save pleasure? I say in themselves, for there is still another fruit of glory—it increases power. For it makes us loved or feared. We seek beautiful things because they are pleasant, for I define beauty as that, the contemplation of which is pleasant.” (A. VI, i, 464; L. 136-137). Nevertheless, as Rutherford observes, “Although Leibniz distances himself from Stoicism in the Theodicy, rejecting the “forced patience” of the Stoics, his conception of divine justice is at many points closer to Stoicism than to Christianity.” (Rutherford 1997, 89).

Leibniz often explicitly connects justice with happiness and the pursuit of our own interests. He draws from the Stoic idea that the optimal way to be happy is the rational recognition of God’s justice which governs the world. The happiness of rational minds comes from the understanding that God actualized the best possible world. Such recognition is pleasurable and leads to happiness. While particular circumstances may appear to be unjust, rational minds understand that God’s justice eventually rewards the virtuous and punishes the wicked. Put differently, Leibniz agrees with the Stoics that happiness comes from contentment and appreciation that the world must unfold exactly as it does (though, to be sure, they disagreed about the reasons why the world must unfold as it does). For Leibniz, the unfolding of the world is not a necessary consequence, but instead is a result of God’s desire to create the best possible world. To protest the events or features of this world would be as irrational as protesting the logos described by the Stoics.

In a pivotal passage in the Theodicy, Leibniz explains that God’s justice weighs competing goods, and that some may suffer for the greater good of the whole. He illustrates this point with the example of Jonah from the Hebrew Bible and Old Testament. In this story, God tells Jonah to go to the city of Nineveh to convince the inhabitants to repent for their wicked actions lest harm would befall them. In his charge to Jonah, God describes the pain that would befall everyone in the city, not just the human inhabitants. Leibniz writes, “When God justified to the Prophet Jonah the pardon that he had granted to the inhabitants of Nineveh, he even touched upon the interest of the beasts who would have been involved in the ruin of the great city. No substance is contemptible or absolutely precious before God.” (G. VI, 169; H 191)

Leibniz distinguishes three different kinds of goodness: metaphysical goodness, physical goodness, and moral goodness. Metaphysical goodness is drawn from the Platonic notion that being is convertible with goodness, or to put it differently, something is metaphysically good insofar as it exists. Importantly, since there are degrees of existence in Leibniz’s metaphysics, there are also degrees of metaphysical goodness such that the greater degree of reality something possesses, the more metaphysically good it is. In this sense, God is maximally metaphysically good because God contains the greatest degree of reality. Physical goodness is identified by Leibniz with pleasure. Finally, moral goodness is identified with virtue or acting according to wisdom.

Leibniz is clear that while God is concerned with the happiness of all minds, it does not follow that the happiness of each and every individual mind is God’s principal aim; rather, God is concerned with the good of the whole. As Rutherford writes, “God has chosen the best possible order for the world, one that best accords with the dictates of wisdom, and within this order rational minds will enjoy varying degrees of happiness, in proportion to the degrees of metaphysical goodness intrinsic to their natures.” (Rutherford 1997, 90) In short, Leibniz agrees with the Stoic view that the order and harmony exemplified in the best possible world is a reflection of God’s perfection. And the rational recognition of God’s perfection leads to pleasure, happiness, and virtue.

c. Natural Law, Prudentialism, and the Psychological Egoist Tradition

Leibniz was also influenced by the 17^th century tradition of egoist moral psychology, most notably from Hobbes and Spinoza. Like the broader prudentialist tradition, these thinkers held that voluntary action requires the perception of some good. Hobbes and Spinoza go further, however, and argue the perceived good motivating the actions of voluntary agents is connected to their own advantage, preservation, utility, or pleasure. Leibniz follows this stronger motivational framework in his moral psychology and natural law theory. Leibniz’s writings throughout his career make clear that he is not only a consistent prudentialist who thinks that action is necessarily oriented toward an agent’s own good, but also a psychological egoist who thinks that action is motivated by what an agent perceives as conducive to their own pleasure or advantage. Yet, for Leibniz, such pleasure must be guided by rational wisdom, since agents frequently mistake their apparent good for their actual good. For more, see the entry on psychological egoism.

Leibniz first read Hobbes’s De Cive in 1668 (perhaps as early as 1664) and received Spinoza’s Tractatus Theologico Politicus in October 1669. The psychological egoist tradition argued that voluntary action is necessarily motivated by what agents perceive to be their own highest good. In the Nova Methodus, Leibniz writes, “To will is nothing but the striving arising from thought or to strive for something which our thinking recognizes as good.” (A. VI, i, 284; NM 21). One might think that Leibniz’s project is to distinguish between the good motivating our action (necessarily our own pleasure) and the good sought by action (possibly another’s welfare as an end in itself), but this is incompatible with his repeated insistence that we seek the good of those we love “for the sake of the pleasure which we ourselves get from their happiness.” Put differently, another’s happiness is not pursued independently of the agent’s good; rather, Leibniz’s key insight is that we can think of another’s good as if it is our good. Leibniz’s view is that the good of others ultimately contributes to one’s own perfection. The good sought is ultimately one’s own good, but one’s properly understood good includes the flourishing of others.

While prudential philosophers argued that all rational agents are inclined to do that which is perceived as their own good, this does not mean, of course, that everything rational agents do is for their own good, since we can sometimes misunderstand that which is good. Leibniz believed that it was a matter of natural law that rational agents must act on their own perceived goods. As Brown writes, “For Leibniz, then, it seems that there can be no obligation without motivation, and no motivation without concern for one’s own good.” (Brown 2016, 23-24). This is consistent with Leibniz’s position in the Elementa where he states that “…prudence cannot be separated from our own good, and whatever they may say against it is both empty and alien to the practice itself of those speaking. There is no one who deliberately does anything except on account of his own good, for we even seek the good of those whom we love on account of our own pleasure, which we receive from their happiness.” (A. VI, i, 461; L 134).

Leibniz maintains that we sometimes do not understand what is actually our own good, but we are nevertheless motivated by what is our apparent good. Leibniz reiterates this position throughout his career. For instance, in the Discourse on Metaphysics, he writes that “For it will be found that the demonstration of this predicate of Caesar is not as absolute as those of numbers or of geometry, but that it supposes the sequence of things that God has freely chosen, a sequence based on God’s first free decree always to do what is most perfect and on God’s decrees with respect to human nature, following out of the first decree, that man will always do (although freely) that which appears to be best.” (A. VI, iv, 1548; AG 46, my emphasis).

Leibniz connects the human necessity to be motivated and act by their own perceived self-interest to justice. He writes in the Elementa, “The right reason for our actions is the same as prudence. It follows, therefore, that there can be no justice without prudence. Prudence, furthermore, cannot be separated from our own good…There is no one who deliberately does anything except for the sake of his own good, for we seek the good also of those whom we love for the sake of the pleasure which we ourselves get from their happiness…It follows from this…that no one can be obligated to do evil to himself. What is more, no one can be obligated except for his own good. For since justice is something of which a prudent man can be convinced, and since no one can be convinced of anything except for reasons of his own utility, it follows that every duty must be useful…that every duty (or injustice) is useful (or harmful).” (A. VI, i, 461; L 134).

Leibniz arrives at this insight in jurisprudence with a dilemma he faced in his moral philosophy more generally. According to Leibniz and the prudential tradition of Hobbes and Spinoza, everything we do is for our own perceived advantage. The overwhelming view among commentators is that Leibniz agrees with this position and is committed to the view that no one does anything except out of self-interest, to promote our own welfare. All rational agents, including God, act only for their own sakes in the sense that action necessarily follows from what appears most perfect or good to the agent. Of course, acting in a self-interested way is not the same as acting in a selfish way, where selfish actions are those done at the expense of others. For Leibniz, self-interest is rational, and it is rational to promote the good of others as if it were our own good. In this way, Leibniz orients a prudentialism and psychological egoism to justice, understood as rational love.

Natural law cannot be separated from prudence. The person acting must have an advantage. Moreover, he also disagrees, as we will see below, with Grotius’s position that justice cannot be separated from God (at least hypothetically). For without God there would be no compensatory justice in the afterlife. If we suppose the existence of God, then we can act in some ways that do not directly benefit us so long as we suppose an afterlife where justice could be completed. Without God, Leibniz’s highest degree of natural justice becomes meaningless.

d. Christian Ethics

Not only was Leibniz’s practical philosophy influenced by Roman Law, Stoicism, and the Natural Law tradition, he was also influenced by Christian ethics from the thought of Jesus and St. Paul. In the early 1670’s while he was still in Mainz working in the court of Christian von Boineburg, Leibniz worked diligently on a text called the Elementa. The text was never published and is comprised of a series of attempts to define justice. In these drafts, Leibniz first incorporates the Christian view to love one’s neighbor in his own theory of justice by relating justice back to earlier concepts of pleasure and happiness. Leibniz writes, “We love a thing whose happiness causes our own pleasure.” (A. VI, i, 457).

In the fourth set of notes from the Elementa, Leibniz writes, “There is a twofold way of desiring the good of others; one is for our good [propter nostrum], the other as if it were our good [quasi nostrum]. The former is that of the calculating man, the latter is that of the lover. The former is the affection of a master toward his servant, the latter of a father toward his son; the former of one in need toward an instrument, the latter of a lover toward his beloved. One is desired for the sake of something other than the good of others, another for the sake of the good of others itself. But, you ask, how is it possible that another’s good be the same as our own, and yet sought for its own sake? For another’s good can be our own good in another way, as a means, but not an end. In truth, and on the contrary, I reply: it can be our good as an end and desired in itself when it is pleasant. Now all pleasant things are desired in themselves, and whatever is desired in itself is pleasant; other things are desired for the sake of what is pleasant, according as they produce it, preserve it, or eliminate opposing things.” (A. VI, i. 464; L 136).

Leibniz argues that we can love others as if it were our own good (not for our own good; see Brown 2011) because increasing our pleasure is not a means, but an end. In a letter to Claude Nicaise in 1697, Leibniz describes this most clearly, “…it is evident from the notion of love…how we seek at the same time our good for ourselves and the good of the beloved object for itself, when the good of this object is immediately, finally (: ultimato :) and in itself our end, our pleasure, and our good—as happens in regard to all things desired because they are pleasing in themselves, and are consequently good of themselves, even if one should have no regard to consequences; these are ends and not means.” (A. II, iii, 369).

But if everything we do is for our own advantage, then why should we care at all about the good of others? Put differently, how do we reconcile psychological egoism, the view that humans are always motivated by self-interest, with altruism, the view that sometimes humans can act in ways that are not motivated by self-interest? On the fact of it, these views seem inherently contradictory, but Leibniz thinks they can be reconciled with a proper understanding of justice and love. He writes, “But how are these views reconciled with what was said above, where we said that nothing can be desired by us except on account of our good, when we now deny that another’s good is to be desired for the sake of our own? It will be reconciled, no doubt, in a way which is noticed by only a few. A bright light can arise from there, for true jurisprudence as well as for true theology. And this matter depends upon the nature of love.” (A. VI, i, 463-464; L 136).

2. Foundations of Leibniz’s Jurisprudence

In contemporary philosophy, it is not uncommon for ethical theories to be supported without an underlying systematic metaphysical or epistemological structure. In the 17^th and 18^th centuries, however, philosophical “system-building” was typical. Such system building was perhaps best represented in Spinoza’s thought through his masterpiece, Ethics. While Leibniz did not have a single text which distilled all his philosophy into one unified narrative, it would be a mistake to think that his philosophy was not a coherent system. The predominant view among Leibniz scholars is that, while his thought changed and developed over the course of a long career, Leibniz strived for a coherent philosophical system where the metaphysical and epistemological insights informed, supported, and did not contradict, other areas of his thought. As a result of this goal, Leibniz’s theory of law and justice was not a distinct area of his thought, divorced from his metaphysics, epistemology, or philosophical theology.

Leibniz thought that law was not only a human convention, but it could also provide metaphysical and theological insights. He reasoned that since jurisprudence is a science, it can, like all sciences, provide knowledge of the necessary truths which govern the universe. It is partly for this reason that he was so adamant that law needed a foundation in definitions and logic. In fact, he begins the Nova Methodus by defining jurisprudence as “the science of the law connected to a case or fact.” (A. VI, i, 293; NM 31). As Riley notes, “Leibniz is a supremely architectonic thinker who wants to relate everything to “first philosophy,” so one cannot just cordon off his moral and political thought from his metaphysics and theology: that is precisely what he himself did not do.” (Riley 1996, 5).

Leibniz’s a priori method for trying to establish a universal jurisprudence based on reason was influenced heavily by Euclid and Hobbes. Leibniz held that the precepts of natural law can be deduced from basic definitions through analysis. Once we have a clear definition of a term such as “justice” or “right,” we can analyze and deduce what precepts follow from those definitions. This method is functionally identical to the way that geometers work, too. For example, once we have the definition of a triangle as a polygon with three sides whose interior angles measure 180 degrees, we can formulate the precept for how to create a triangle. Put simply, normative precepts follow from metaphysical definitions in jurisprudence, just as they do in geometry. Leibniz writes in his “Opinion on the Principles of Pufendorf” from 1706, “Neither the norm of conduct itself, nor the essence of the just, depends on his [God’s] free decision, but rather on eternal truths, objects of the divine intellect, which constitute, so to speak, the essence of divinity itself… And, indeed, justice follows certain rules of equality and of proportion [which are] no less founded in the immutable nature of things, and in the divine ideas, than are the principles of arithmetic and of geometry.” (PW 71, my emphasis).

Of course, part of the issue with any attempt at establishing a priori truths is that the definitions and axioms of which these truths are allegedly derived may not be self-evident. Leibniz begins with definitions for ‘right’, ‘justice’, and ‘obligation’, but Hobbes begins with very different definitions. Why should one set be preferred more than another? Similarly, Aristotle and Grotius define humans as naturally social animals, whereas Hobbes insists that society is an artificial construction precisely because we are not social animals. It is difficult (impossible?) to establish either claim in an a priori fashion. Despite his ardent desire to analyze the law in an a priori fashion, Leibniz, like those in the natural law tradition before him, draws on empirical observations about human nature and then universalizes those properties as something necessary and universal to humans.

On the basis of Leibniz’s contention that jurisprudence is a science of right, he derives three degrees of natural justice (jus naturale): harm no one (jus strictum), give each his due (aequitas), and live honorably (pietas). The degrees of natural justice conform to the basic tenets of Roman Law (Digest 1.10), but are founded on a priori principles instead of historical, contingent facts. Moreover, the degrees of natural justice reflect Aristotle’s differing conceptions of justice in Nicomachean Ethics (Book V, Chapters 3 and 4): the mandate to harm no one applies to commutative justice, the mandate to give each his due reflects distributive justice, and the precept to live honorably reflects Aristotle’s conception of universal justice. Leibniz argues that the degrees of natural justice are not competing with each other, but “perfect and strengthen” the previous degree (A. VI, i, 343; NM 169).

While the first two degrees of natural justice are similarly found in Grotius, one of Leibniz’s insights is that strict right, equity, and piety differ in degree, not type; that is, the degrees of natural justice are continuous. Moreover, as we move from the lowest degree of natural justice to the highest, we are moving from particular justice to universal justice. Put simply, we move from the most particular mandate to not harm another to the most universal precept to love everyone, guided by wisdom. In fact, wisdom is the mechanism to move from the lower degrees of natural justice to the higher degrees. The more that we understand, the more we can imitate God and take pleasure in the rational contemplation of the perfection of others.

In the Codex, Leibniz will make it clear that the three degrees of natural justice are all grounded in the concern for our own self-interest, that is, they are grounded in our own happiness. But we are happiest when we reflect the perfections of others. He writes, “And pure or strict right in fact arises from the principle of preserving peace; equity or charity strives for something higher, that while each benefits others as much as he can, he may increase his happiness in that of another. And to state it briefly, strict right avoids misery, superior right aims for happiness…” (A. IV, v, 62-63). Rendered this way, Leibniz’s moral psychology is best understood in relation to his theory of natural law.

a. Jus Strictum (Strict Right)—Harm No One

The first degree of natural justice, according to Leibniz, is jus strictum, or strict right. It is the mandate to ‘harm no one’. He writes, “Strict or pure right derives from the definition of terms, and when rightly weighed, is nothing other than the right of war and peace.” (A. VI, i, 343; NM 169). Notice that Leibniz suggests strict right derives from a ‘definition of terms’, reiterating that his account is not drawn from the historical experience of judges and lawyers in the Roman empire, but through an a priori analysis. Strict right is based on the analysis of terms deriving from even more basic notions such as right (jus) and obligation (obligatio).

Moreover, following a long tradition in natural law, Leibniz argued in the Nova Methodus that persons have rights to their own bodies and property. The precept of strict right simply follows from earlier definitions of concepts like “person” and “bodies” and “property”. We are in a state of peace when no one has violated our strict right, and when someone injures our bodies or possessions, we move from the state of peace to a state of war. For example, assault, battery, and murder are unjust, then, because they violate strict right and move persons from a state of peace to a state of war. On the same reasoning, stealing is also an injustice because it injures another.

b. Aequitas (Equity)—Give Each His Due

The second degree of natural justice, Leibniz argues, is aequitas, or equity. Equity is the precept to give to each his due. Whereas strict right followed Aristotle’s account of commutative justice, equity concerns distributive justice. While strict right applies to everyone equally, equity does not; equity requires giving to each what is deserved based on merit, which varies from person to person and circumstance to circumstance. For example, suppose that someone steals food when they are starving. Jus strictum would dictate that one must not harm, where harm includes injuries to property like theft. Strict right applies to everyone equally. But at the level of aequitas, we might rationally consider more of the context of the situation, perhaps that the person was starving, and judge them differently than if they stole out of malice.

Leibniz describes this second degree of natural justice, “equity or equality, that is, the ratio or proportion between two or more, consists in harmony or congruence. This coincides with the principles of Aristotle, Grotius, and Felden. This requires that, for he who harms me, no murderous war is perpetuated, but rather restitution.” (A. VI, i, 343; NM 170). He then goes on to explain equity in terms of what he calls “the rule of reason and of our Lord,” sometimes called “the silver rule,” the negative formulation of “the golden rule.” He writes, “what you do not wish to be done to you, or what you do wish to be done to you, do not do to others, or do not deny to others.” (A. VI. i, 344; NM 170). It is interesting that Leibniz attributes the silver rule, and not the golden rule, to be “the rule of reason and of our Lord.”

Whereas strict right is a mandate to give what is owed; equity is a precept to give what is deserved, that is, treat others in a way that they deserve based on the merits of the case. Perhaps most important to emphasize with respect to equity is the sense in which it demands more of a moral agent than strict right. Below we will see that this carries over into the third degree, piety, as well.

c. Pietas (Piety)—Live Piously

Leibniz refers to the third degree of natural right as pietas or piety, and, like the other degrees, corresponds to a precept found in Roman Law. In this case, the precept is to “live honorably” (honeste vivere). Whereas strict right concerned Aristotle’s notion of commutative justice and equity corresponded to his notion of distributive justice, piety corresponds to Aristotle’s notion of “universal justice.” Leibnizian piety involves loving everyone such that we rationally recognize their perfections and take pleasure in them.

Leibniz’s keen insight with respect to piety is that whereas the first and second degrees of natural right compel us not to harm another and to give each his due, Leibniz reasons that following these commands are consistent with not helping to promote the good of others when there is a lesser cost to ourselves. In other words, if we only had strict right and equity guiding our conduct, then our only moral obligations would be not to harm others and give others their due, not the stronger mandate to promote their good, that is, to be charitable. In the Codex, Leibniz goes as far as to identify equity with charity, in a particular sense. He writes, “the higher degree I call equity, or, if you prefer, charity (that is, in the narrower sense).” (A. IV, v, 62; L 422). For example, if Smith is drowning in water and Jones has the ability to intervene to help, there is no obligation for Jones to do so on the basis of strict right or equity alone. But on the basis of piety, Jones is compelled to will their good as well.

Although it is not explicit in the text, Leibniz seems to be combining different elements of strict right and equity for an understanding of piety. From strict right, Leibniz draws the sense that justice demands that we treat everyone equally, and from equity, Leibniz draws the sense that justice demands not just a prohibition against injuring another, but the stronger sense that we ought to promote the good of others by giving them what they deserve. Piety goes even further. It is the precept to love everyone because it is what is owed as creatures bearing perfection and created in the image of God.

Leibniz’s use of piety in the early Nova Methodus is complicated by the fact that he defines it there as “the will of the superior” (A. VI, i, 344; NM 171), and speaks approvingly of Thrasymachus, Socrates’s interlocutor in the Republic who argued that justice is the advantage of the strong. In later texts, Leibniz understands justice and piety very differently, as grounded not in the will, but the understanding. One interpretative option is to suggest that Leibniz’s view changed from the earlier text when his fascination with Hobbes’s theory of justice clearly began to wane. Alternatively, some scholars have attempted to explain “superior” in a way which is consistent with later texts. Leibniz reiterates again that piety is the “perfection and execution” of strict right and equity. (A. VI, i, 344; NM 171).

Piety is the most distinct of the degrees of natural right because it is the only degree that explicitly requires God to help explain its meaning and to connect it with Roman law. Leibniz writes, “Hence the precept: to live honorably. Whenever strict right and equity lack the physical bond, God helps to bring it about so that what is useful to the public, that is, what is useful for humanity and the world, is also made useful for the individual, and thus everything honorable is useful, and everything dishonorable harmful….The existence then of the wisest and most powerful being, or God, is the ultimate foundation of natural right, which for us is demonstrated with mathematical certainty, and when shown to the public, will entirely dissipate the truth-covering cloud of the atheists.” (A. VI, i, 344; NM 171-172).

God is the foundation of natural justice not because he arbitrarily decided that certain moral precepts are good, but because God’s wisdom discerned these universal practical truths. Insofar as human agents want to express the highest degree of natural law, they ought to emulate God’s perfections. Put simply, the ultimate foundation of justice lies in God’s nature as a perfectly rational being.

Piety also demands that we love others disinterestedly. And we should love others because they are rational creatures created in the image of God. Moreover, such love increases our own happiness. In loving the perfections of others, we increase our own pleasure, and by extension, promote our own happiness. We come to know the perfections of God by loving the perfections of others. He writes in a text the Akademie editors have called “An Introduction on the Value and Method of Natural Science,” “The more one can give reasons for his (God’s) love, the more one loves God. To find joy in the perfection of another—this is the essence of love. Thus the highest function of our mind is the knowledge of what is here the same thing, the love of the most perfect being, and it is from this that the maximum or the most enduring joy, that is, felicity, must arise.” (L 280)

The emphasis on knowledge as a necessary condition for a proper understanding of justice clearly indicates the intellectualist strand of Leibniz’s practical philosophy. Knowledge is insufficient though since we must love others to imitate the moral exemplar, God, thereby increasing our perfection and happiness. He writes in the Méditation, “One cannot envisage in God any other motive than that of perfection, or, if you like, of his pleasure; supposing (according to my definition) that pleasure is nothing but a feeling of perfection, he has nothing to consider outside himself; on the contrary everything depends on him. But his goodness would not be supreme if he did not aim at the good and at perfection so far as is possible. But what will one say, if I show that this same motive has a place in truly virtuous and generous men, whose supreme function [degré] is to imitate divinity, in so far as human nature is capable of it?” (PW 57-58)

God is only mentioned in the highest degree of justice for it is here that Leibniz argues that justice ought to be pursued as an end itself. This does not mean, however, that justice is pursued as an end in itself at the expense of the self-interested pursuit of pleasure and happiness. Rather, Leibniz contends that we ought to model human justice on divine justice where we pursue pleasure and happiness out of self-interest. Rutherford explains how these elements come together, writing, “To pursue justice for its own sake is to pursue one’s own highest good, since an agent’s virtue is the perfection of her powers. But an agent who acts in this way, imitating God, also seeks the greatest good of all intelligent creatures. Thus, there is a convergence of Leibniz’s perfectionism, which gives priority to an agent’s full realization of her capacities for virtuous action, and his consequentialism, which identifies the end of virtuous action with the promotion of the greatest good of all.” (Rutherford 2014).

It is also critical to point out that Leibniz’s theory of justice, and piety in particular, is incomplete without consideration of the afterlife. The afterlife is the mechanism by which a wise and benevolent God ultimately punishes and rewards those that escape justice on Earth. He writes, “One cannot doubt, in fact, that the ruler of the universe, at once most wise and most powerful, has allotted rewards for the good and punishments for the wicked, and that his plan will be put into effect in a future life, since in present life many crimes remain without punishment and without recompense. Therefore, to set aside…the consideration of the future life, which is inseparably connected to divine providence, and to be content with an inferior degree of natural law, which can be valid for atheists…, would mean cutting off the best part of the science [of law], and suppressing many duties in this life as well…More sublime and perfect is the theory of natural law according to the Christian doctrine…, or rather of the true philosophers, [namely] that not everything should be measured by the goods of this life.” (PW 67)

Although hope of reward and fear of punishment are powerful motives, Leibniz thought that they were “calculating” or “mercenary” motives, and that the truly just man was motivated by “disinterested” love. We can discern the nature of this kind of love by mirroring God, to the extent possible, as a moral exemplar. After all, God is not moved to act from hope or fear. Leibniz writes in his remarks against Pufendorf, “he who acts well, not out of hope or fear, but by an inclination of his soul, is so far from not behaving justly that, on the contrary, he acts more justly than all others, imitating, in a certain way, as a man, divine justice.” (PW, 72). Leibniz writes in his Codex that “disinterested” or “pure love” is key to understanding justice. “It is independent of hope, of fear, and of regard for any question of utility. In truth, the happiness of those whose happiness pleases us turns into our own happiness, since things which please us are desired for their own sake.” (Leibniz PW, 171).

3. Caritas Sapientis: Justice as the Charity of the Wise

Perhaps Leibniz’s most famous motto in his moral and political philosophy was his assertion that “justice is the charity of the wise”—caritas sapientis, first explicitly described in the Codex from 1693. Even as early as the Elementa from 1670-1671, Leibniz already connected love and wisdom, but he did not give the exact formulation of justice as the charity of the wise until later. Leibniz’s position is best understood as a critical reaction to Hobbes who thought of justice as defined by the will of God. For Leibniz, justice is not derived through the will, but through the understanding of God. In the Méditation, he writes, “Wisdom, which is the knowledge of our own good, brings us to justice, that is to say, to a reasonable advancement of the good of others.” (PW 57).

In a letter to Claude Nicaise in 1697, Leibniz draws together the concepts of justice, wisdom, and charity. He writes, “For justice is fundamentally nothing other than charity in conformity with wisdom. Charity is a universal benevolence. Benevolence is a disposition or inclination to love, and it has the same relation to love that habit has to act. And love is this act or active state of the soul, which makes us find our pleasure in the felicity or satisfaction of others.” (A. II. iii, 368-369).

The debate in scholasticism and early modern philosophy regarding voluntarism fundamentally shaped Leibniz’s mature attitude toward justice understood as the charity of the wise. For Leibniz, the will is inclined to the good, and the intellect discerns the good. A perfectly just individual is one that emulates God’s perfections so that she infallibly understands that which is good and are invariably moved to it. In this way, Leibniz believed that the understanding was the faculty used to determine how to achieve what is desired. Put differently, the understanding provides the playbook, and the will executes the strategy. The desire to pursue self-interest is already antecedent to the will and intellect. In this way, Leibniz’s position is similar in structure to the Platonic framework. The role of reason is to guide us to what is actually good, rather than what is merely a perceived or apparent good. As Brown frames it, “Leibniz held that it is an agent’s desire for his own happiness or perfection that is ultimately the source of real obligation; an agent’s desire for his own happiness is the source of practical normativity, which reason then transfers from that end to those means that it has calculated for securing it.” (Brown 2016).

Justice involving the understanding was shaped by the scholastic debate concerning moral ontology. On one side of the debate were naturalists such as Gregory of Rimini who took up Socrates’s position that the moral good existed independently of God’s will. On the other side were voluntarists like William of Ockham (1280-1349) who argued that the good was contingent on God’s will. Francisco Suarez (1548-1617), in some ways, settled this debate by arguing for a middle ground between medieval scholastic naturalists and voluntarists. By distinguishing between God as a creator and lawgiver, Suarez argued that the voluntarists were right with respect to law and wrong with respect to morality, and the naturalists were right with respect to morality and wrong with respect to law. The result was Suarez’s contention that while the moral good derives from God’s nature as creator, the obligation to follow those laws comes from God’s nature as lawgiver. So, Pufendorf was a voluntarist with respect to morality and obligation, Grotius was a naturalist with respect to morality and obligation, and Suarez split the difference and was a naturalist about morality, but a voluntarist about law. (See Irwin 2008; Olsthoorn 2019).

Leibniz revered Grotius in the scholastic debate and fiercely criticized Pufendorf’s voluntarism, which Leibniz equated to a kind of arbitrary tyranny. Leibniz writes in a letter to Molanus in 1698, “God does not act through absolute power alone, without reason, as would a tyrant, and it is always his supreme wisdom which makes him choose the best-though the reasons for this depth of his counsel may be unknown to us. Thus the love of God and the respect which we owe him is not injured at all; his wisdom his goodness, and his justice remain in their entirety, as well as his power and his supreme right…This sovereign master does not act without reason, or by some obscure movement of his power alone, which would be the act of a tyrant, but through reasons (however unknown to us) which his perfections furnish to him: in a word, sovereign wisdom, has as much of a role as sovereign power.” (A. I, xvii, 609).

Leibniz explicitly references the Euthyphro in his Méditation, which he says deals with whether “it is good and just because God wills it or whether God wills it because it is good and just: in other words, whether justice and goodness are arbitrary or whether they belong to the necessary and eternal truths about the nature of things, as do numbers and proportions,” (PW 45), showing his allegiance to the positions of Plato and Grotius. It is Leibniz’s more mature position that Hobbes is mistaken in reducing justice to power, for, as he writes in the Discourse, “in saying that things are not good by virtue of any rule of goodness but solely by virtue of the will of God, it seems to me that we unknowingly destroy all of God’s love and all his glory. For why praise him for what he has done if he would be equally praiseworthy in doing the exact contrary? Where will his justice and wisdom reside if there remains only a certain despotic power, if will holds the place of reason, and if, according to the definition of tyrants, justice consists in whatever pleases the most powerful?” (A.VI, iv, 1532-1533; AG 36).

In the Méditation, Thrasymachus and Hobbes make another appearance in the text, and Leibniz is overtly critical of their view. He writes that if Thrasymachus is right, then “there would never be a sentence of a sovereign court, nor of a supreme judge, which would be unjust, nor would an evil but powerful man ever be blameworthy. And what is more, the same action could be just or unjust, depending on the judges who decide, which is ridiculous.” (PW 47) Leibniz immediately continues that Hobbes “wished to uphold almost the same thing as Thrasymachus: for he wants God to have the right to do everything, because he is all-powerful. This is a failure to distinguish between right and fact.” (PW 47, my emphasis) Not only does voluntarism reduce God’s justice to be a matter of arbitrary will, but it also detracts from the reasons that we love God. If God can will that both x and ~x are good, then goodness itself is independent of God, a creation of the divine. But then we cannot love God on the basis of his goodness, for goodness is not an essential part of his nature.

For Leibniz, God’s goodness, wisdom, and justice agree with the necessary truths. Our reason and God’s reason are continuous. There is no gap between human and divine wisdom. This separates Leibniz’s position from the other German political movement going on led by Pufendorf. In the Méditation, Leibniz argues that “Justice is nothing else than that which conforms to wisdom and goodness joined together.” (PW 50) For Leibniz, then, justice is not merely a matter of the will as Hobbes held, nor a matter purely of the understanding, but rather when they are working harmoniously in concert.

4. Key Concepts in Leibniz’s Philosophy of Law

Leibniz’s moral philosophy and jurisprudence have been interpreted quite differently from commentators due in large part to two facts. First, Leibniz wrote extensively on these topics from the 1660’s until his death in 1716. Second, Leibniz emphasizes different elements of his thought depending on the audience. The predominant interpretation in the secondary literature is that while he was influenced by the traditions described above, Leibniz is a consequentialist and perfectionist, emphasizing both that the just and unjust are that which is “useful or harmful to the public” (A. VI, i, 300-301; NM 50), and that the good demands the maximization of pleasure, happiness, and perfection. (See Brown 2011, Rutherford 1995 and 2014, and Schneewind 1998, for instance). Others have interpreted Leibniz’s moral philosophy as grounded in deontic concepts in a way that foreshadows Kant’s emphasis on autonomy and rights. (See Johns 2006 and 2013 and Darwall 2023). Others have argued that Leibniz’s moral philosophy is best understood in light of ancient traditions, emphasizing either Plato’s moral rationalism (Riley 1996 and Mercer 2004) or the eudaemonism from Aristotle (Irwin 2008 and Dong 2024). Part of the difficulty in understanding Leibniz’s practical philosophy is that he describes several things as “the good,” including pleasure, happiness, justice, love, and perfection. Understanding the way these concepts fit together is key to understanding Leibniz’s practical philosophy.

a. Pleasure

Leibniz is sometimes considered to be a psychological hedonist who understands that pleasure is the highest good. While this general statement may be true, there are a few caveats to avoid being potentially misleading. The first caveat is that he is not just referring to physical pleasure, but to the pleasures of the mind as well, which are even more important. He argues that we gain pleasure from our perceptions. Sometimes these pleasures come from increasing our own perfections and sometimes they come from our rational reflection of the best possible world. He writes, “Pleasure is the feeling of some perfection, and this perfection which causes pleasure can be found not only in ourselves, but also elsewhere…For when we ourselves are aware of it, this knowledge itself excites some perfection in us because the representation of perfection is also a perfection. Thus there is no doubt that he who consorts much with excellent people or things becomes himself more excellent.” (G. VII, 86). These distinct sources of pleasure are easily reconcilable, though, for Leibniz holds that happiness comes from rational knowledge, and we can share this rational knowledge with others when we can share in their happiness.

b. Perfection and Happiness

Leibniz connects pleasure with perfection, writing, “The first cause is of the highest possible goodness, for while it produces as much perfection as possible in things, at the same time it bestows on minds as much pleasure as possible, since pleasure consists in the perception of perfection.” (G. VII, 291). He generally held that the good is “what contributes to the perfection, and hence to the pleasure, of intelligent substances…” (Brown 1995, 412-413).

In his writings dealing more with metaphysical issues, he argues that everything that exists has some degree of perfection. Since everything that exists has a degree of perfection, and pleasure is connected with perfection, Leibniz maintains that God acts in a way to maximize pleasure and perfection. The just person is able to rationally recognize these perfections and maximize them to the extent possible. In this sense, when God actualizes the best of all possible worlds, God brings about the state of affairs with the most perfections.

In one pivotal piece that may give a competing explanation for the creation of the world apart from the standard theodical story, Leibniz suggests that possible objects compete for existence, with the actual world being the result of the possibles with the most perfections succeeding. He writes in a piece called “The Ultimate Origination of Things,” “in order to explain a bit more distinctly how temporal, contingent, or physical truths arise from eternal, essential, or metaphysical truths we must first acknowledge that since something rather than nothing exists, there is a certain urge for existence or (so to speak) a straining toward existence in possible things or in possibility or essence itself; in a word, essence in and of itself strives for existence. Furthermore, it follows from this that all possibles, that is, everything that expresses essence or possible reality strive with equal right for existence in proportion to the amount of essence or reality or the degree of perfection they contain for perfection is nothing but the amount of essence.” (G. VII. 303; AG 150)

Leibniz is also clear that while pleasure is our highest good, happiness is our ultimate aim, for happiness is a state of lasting pleasure. Happiness can only be guided by reason, since without reason, we would invariably choose more immediate pleasures which do not contribute to our lasting happiness. In the Nouveaux Essais, Leibniz writes, “To speak against reason is to speak against truth, because reason is a chain of truths. It is to speak against oneself, and against one’s own good, since the principal point of reason consists in knowing and pursuing the good…. True happiness ought always to be the object of our desires, but there is reason to doubt that it is. For often we scarcely think of it, and I have here pointed out more than once that unless appetite is guided by reason, it tends toward present pleasure and not toward happiness, that is to say, toward lasting pleasure, although it does aim to make it last.” (A. VI, vi, 199-200; RB 199-200).

c. Love

It was mentioned earlier that Leibniz spent a great deal of time reconciling different philosophical views. Perhaps the most important area of his practical philosophy where this tendency manifests was his attempt to bring together egoism and altruism. Leibniz traces this problem to the challenge of the ancient skeptic, Carneades, who argued that justice required consideration of others instead of ourselves, which was contrary to human nature and foolish. In fact, Leibniz is sympathetic to Carneades early in his career, writing in a letter to Herman Conring in 1670, “I suppose with Carneades (and Hobbes agrees) that justice without one’s own advantage (whether present or future) is the height of folly, for the arrogant boastings of the Stoics and the Sadducees about virtue practiced for its own sake are far removed from human nature. Consequently, every just thing must be personally beneficial.” (A. II, i, 47). Of course, Leibniz will later contend that loving others is to our own advantage, and is not only not the height of folly, but also the highest degree of justice.

Leibniz’s response to Carneades comes in the Elementa when he first incorporated love into his theory of justice. A proper understanding of love, in particular, disinterested love, is both the way to respond to Carneades, and also resolve the dilemma between altruistically seeking the good of others at the expense of ourselves on the one hand and preserving the essential human nature that we always seek our own good. Rational reflection and wisdom help us to understand that the good of others is our good. In other words, Carneades was wrong because he frames justice as “the height of folly” because he thought of human action in terms of a false dilemma. We must, Carneades thought, think either of ourselves or others. But Leibniz argues instead that we can consider our good by considering the good of others. We can consider their good as if it were our good.

In the fourth draft of the Elementa, Leibniz defines justice in a way that connects with prudence. He writes, “Justice will therefore be the habit of loving others (or of seeking the good of others in itself and taking pleasure in the good of others), insofar as it can come about through prudence (prudentiam] (or as long as it is not the cause of greater pain). (A. VI, i, 465; L 137). In the fifth draft of the Elementa, Leibniz argues that “the good person (the vir bonus) is whoever that loves all.” (A. VI. i, 466). In this way, he connects his theory of justice in the early 1670s with the third degree of natural justice, described in the Nova Methodus, namely, piety or charity.

In the same text, Leibniz comes to his “true and perfect definition of justice” as “the habit of loving others, or taking pleasure from the expectation of another’s good whenever the occasion occurs. It is equitable to love all others whenever the occasion arises. We are obligated to do that which is equitable. It is unjust not to be delighted by the good of another whenever the occasion arises. The just (what is permitted) is whatever is not unjust. Therefore, justice is not only what is equitable—to be delighted by the good of another when the occasion arises—but also whatever is not unjust—to do what you please whenever an issue does not arise. Right is the power of doing what is just.” (A. VI, i, 465; AG 137).

By the time of the Codex, Leibniz explicitly brings his account of love together with a response to Carneades. He also incorporates divine love as a model for which to strive, again harkening back to pietas as the only degree of natural justice to involve God. He writes, “By moral, however, I mean something equivalent to natural for a good man, for as a Roman jurisconsult has well said, we should believe that we are incapable of doing things which are contrary to good morals. A good man is one who loves all men, so far as reason permits. Therefore, if I am not mistaken, we may most fittingly define justice, which is the virtue governing that affection which the Greeks call philanthropy, as the charity of the wise man, that is, as charity which follows the dictates of wisdom. So the assertion attributed to Carneades, that justice is the highest folly because it bids us consider the interests of others while neglecting our own, is based on ignorance of its definition. Charity is universal benevolence, and benevolence is the habit of loving or of cherishing. But to love or to cherish is to find pleasure in the happiness of another, or what amounts to the same thing, to accept the happiness of another as one’s own. Thus the knotty question of how there can be a disinterested love which is free from hope and fear, and from every consideration of utility, is solved, and in a way that is also of great importance in theology. For the happiness of those whose happiness pleases us is obviously built into our own, since things which please us are desired for their own sake. (A. IV. v, 61).

Sometimes Leibniz speaks of mercenary and non-mercenary love or disinterested love in connection with the constellation of issues related to justice, perfection, and happiness. Mercenary love is when we love another for reasons that benefit us alone. Non-mercenary or disinterested love is when we love another for reasons that benefit the other. Of course, non-mercenary or disinterested love is not completely selfless, for Leibniz thinks that is incompatible with human nature. Rather, non-mercenary or disinterested love occurs when the pleasure we gain comes from another’s happiness. As he writes in the Nouveaux Essais, to love disinterestedly is to “be disposed to take pleasure in the perfection, well-being or happiness of the object of one’s love. And this involves not thinking about or asking for any pleasure of one’s own except what one can get from the happiness or pleasure of the loved one.” (A. VI, vi, 163; RB 163).

Similarly, in a letter to Nicaise in 1698, “to love truly and disinterestedly is nothing other than to be led to find pleasure in the perfections or in the happiness of the object.” (A. II, iii, 441). Loving in this disinterested fashion is ideal because, in imitating the perfections of another, we increase our own perfections. Moreover, those that we emulate increase their own perfections as well because they see their perfections represented in others. As Brown writes, “A community of disinterested lovers is Leibniz’s moral ideal because such a community is driven continuously toward greater perfection by a feedback mechanism based on the infectious nature of perfection itself and of the love that results from it: the perfection of each is reinforced and augmented by the perfection of others, and so the perfection of all is constitutive of the perfection of each.” (Brown 2016, 51).

Leibniz’s repeated use of mirrors throughout his writings practically screams to be connected in this fashion. After all, not only are we striving to increase our pleasure and perfections through emulating other rational agents, but also by mirroring God as the moral exemplar. Put differently, we become happiest, Leibniz thought, not when we are increasing our own perfections in selfish ways at the expense of others, but rather, the happiness of others brings our own happiness because their perfections, including those of God, are reflections of our perfections.

5. Influence and Legacy

While Leibniz’s philosophy of law was studied in the 18^th century (indeed, it heavily influenced French and German jurisprudence), it was overshadowed by the work of his disciple, Christian Wolff. The natural law tradition in moral philosophy and jurisprudence was the predominant way to understand law from the time of Plato until the mid-18^th century. Natural lawyers generally agreed that law needed to be understood in that which is natural. Of course, what is natural varied from philosopher to philosopher, with some emphasizing our roles as rational animals, some emphasizing our roles as social creatures, and some emphasizing our place in the cosmos as created in the image of a wholly good God. Leibniz was one of the last great natural law theorists. In the 18^th century, there are a few related intellectual movements that shifted jurisprudence away from natural law. The most notable shift relevant for understanding the wane of Leibnizian thinking is undoubtedly due to the rise of legal positivism, its empiricist underpinning, and non-cognitivism.

Legal positivism was a competing legal philosophy that was first emphasized by Jeremy Bentham (1748-1832), most notably in his criticism of Blackstone’s common law theory. It held that knowledge was confined to that which is observed, recorded, and measured. Because natural law theorists argued that there is an overlap between morality and law, morality could fill in the gaps when the law is unclear. Leibniz indicates this as early as the Nova Methodus, writing “in those situations which the law has gaps [literally, does not express itself clearly] the case must be judged according to natural law.” (A.VI, i, 341; NM 163). Legal positivism rejected this overlap thesis, and the consequence was that lawyers and judges could no longer appeal to anything except the law itself in its interpretation and execution. One can easily see how legal positivism, steeped in an empiricist epistemology, and grounded upon the denial of any a priori knowledge of God, justice, morality, law, or that which is natural would be antithetical to Leibniz’s project. Finally, non-cognitivism in ethics was a philosophical position which argues that normative statements are neither true nor false. Because moral statements have no truth value, they are outside the scope of reason; put differently, moral claims are not false—they are empty and meaningless. Moreover, because moral statements lack a truth value, it is not even possible for moral claims to be objective. Legal positivism, empiricism, and non-cognitivism were all in stark contrast to Leibniz’s natural law theory, rationalism, and ethical cognitivism.

Legal positivism was extremely influential until the middle of the 20^th century. Following World War II, the Nuremberg trials involved the criminal prosecution of almost two dozen Nazis for war crimes and crimes against humanity. In their defense, the Nazis often insisted that they were following the laws as written and interpreted in Germany. If legal positivism was true and there was nothing to appeal to beyond the law, then those on trial for war crimes may have had a valid defense. What the trial showed, though, was a recognition of human rights that were, in an important sense, beyond the law itself. Current debates in analytic jurisprudence are often not whether one is a natural law theorist (most are not) or a legal positivist (most are), but rather the degree to which morality informs and weighs the interpretation of the law.

6. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

Sämtliche Schriften und Briefe. Ed. Deutsche Akademie der Wissenschaften. Darmstadt, Leipzig, Berlin: Akademie Verlag. Cited by series, volume, page, 1923. [A]
Philosophical Essays. Translated and edited by Roger Ariew and Dan Garber. Indianapolis: Hackett, 1989. [AG]
Die Philosophischen Schriften von Gottfried Wilhelm Leibniz. Ed. C.I. Gerhardt. Berlin: Weidmann, 1875—1890. Reprint, Hildesheim: Georg Olms. Cited by volume, page, 1978. [G]
Theodicy: Essays on the Goodness of God, the Freedom on Man and the Origin of Evil. Translated by E.M. Huggard. La Salle, Illinois: Open Court, 1985. [H]
Philosophical Papers and Letters. Edited and translated by Leroy E. Loemker. 2^nd Edition. Dordrecht: D. Reidel, 1969. [L]
The New Method of Learning and Teaching Jurisprudence. Translated by Carmelo Massimo de Iuliis. Talbot: Clark, New Jersey, 2017. [NM]
Leibniz: Political Writings, Translated and edited by Patrick Riley. 2^nd Edition. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1988. [PW]

b. Secondary Sources

Adams, Robert Merrihew. Leibniz: Determinist, Theist, Idealist. New York: Oxford University Press, 1994.
Adams, Robert Merrihew. “Justice, Happiness, and Perfection in Leibniz’s City of God,” in New Essays on Leibniz’s Theodicy, Larry M. Jorgensen and Samuel Newlands (eds.), Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2014
Blackstone, William. Blackstone’s Commentaries on the Laws of England in Four Volumes, London: Cavendish, 2001.
Blumenfeld, David. “Perfection and Happiness in the Best Possible World,” in The Cambridge Companion to Leibniz, Nicholas Jolley (ed.), Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Brown, Gregory. “Leibniz’s Moral Philosophy,” in The Cambridge Companion to Leibniz, Nicholas Jolley (ed.), Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1995.
Brown, Gregory. “Leibniz’s Moral Philosophy,” in The Continuum Companion to Leibniz, Brandon C. Look (ed.), London: Continuum, 2011.
Brown, Gregory. “Disinterested Love: Understanding Leibniz’s Reconciliation of Self- and Other-Regarding Motives,” British Journal for the History of Philosophy, 19 (2): 265–303, 2011.
Brown, Gregory. “Happiness and Justice,” in The Oxford Handbook of Leibniz, Maria Rosa Antognazza (ed.), Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2013.
Brown, Gregory. “Leibniz on the Ground of Moral Normativity and Obligation,” The Leibniz Review, 26: 11–62, 2016.
Cicero, De Republica and De Legibus, trans. C.W. Keyes, Cambridge: Harvard University Press, 1988.
Darwall, Stephen. Modern Moral Philosophy: From Grotius to Kant. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2023.
Dong, Hao, “Leibniz as a virtue ethicist.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 109: 505-527, 2024.
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Author Information

Joshua Horn
Email: jhorn@uwsp.edu
University of Wisconsin Stevens Point
U. S. A.

Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy