Design Arguments for the Existence of God

Design arguments are empirical arguments for the existence of God. These arguments typically, though not always, proceed by attempting to identify various empirical features of the world that constitute evidence of intelligent design and inferring God’s existence as the best explanation for these features. Since the concepts of design and purpose are closely related, design arguments are also known as teleological arguments, which incorporates “telos,” the Greek word for “goal” or “purpose.”

Design arguments typically consist of (1) a premise that asserts that the material universe exhibits some empirical property F; (2) a premise (or sub-argument) that asserts (or concludes) that F is persuasive evidence of intelligent design or purpose; and (3) a premise (or sub-argument) that asserts (or concludes) that the best or most probable explanation for the fact that the material universe exhibits F is that there exists an intelligent designer who intentionally brought it about that the material universe exists and exhibits F.

There are a number of classic and contemporary versions of the argument from design. This article will cover seven different ones. Among the classical versions are: (1) the “Fifth Way” of St. Thomas Aquinas; (2) the argument from simple analogy; (3) Paley’s watchmaker argument; and (4) the argument from guided evolution. The more contemporary versions include: (5) the argument from irreducible biochemical complexity; (6) the argument from biological information; and (7) the fine-tuning argument.

Table of Contents

1. The Classical Versions of the Design Argument
   1. Scriptural Roots and Aquinas’s Fifth Way
   2. The Argument from Simple Analogy
   3. Paley’s Watchmaker Argument
   4. Guided Evolution
2. Contemporary Versions of the Design Argument
   1. The Argument from Irreducible Biochemical Complexity
   2. The Argument from Biological Information
   3. The Fine-Tuning Arguments
      1. The Argument from Suspicious Improbability
      2. The Confirmatory Argument
3. The Scientifically Legitimate Uses of Design Inferences
4. References and Further Reading

1. The Classical Versions of the Design Argument

a. Scriptural Roots and Aquinas’s Fifth Way

The scriptures of each of the major classically theistic religions contain language that suggests that there is evidence of divine design in the world. Psalms 19:1 of the Old Testament, scripture to both Judaism and Christianity, states that “The heavens declare the glory of God; and the firmament sheweth his handywork.” Similarly, Romans 1:19-21 of the New Testament states:

For what can be known about God is plain to them, because God has shown it to them. Ever since the creation of the world his eternal power and divine nature, invisible though they are, have been understood and seen through the things he has made. So they are without excuse.

Further, Koran 31:20 asks “Do you not see that Allah has made what is in the heavens and what is in the earth subservient to you, and made complete to you His favors outwardly and inwardly?” While these verses do not specifically indicate which properties or features of the world are evidence of God’s intelligent nature, each presupposes that the world exhibits such features and that they are readily discernable to a reasonably conscientious agent.

Perhaps the earliest philosophically rigorous version of the design argument owes to St. Thomas Aquinas. According to Aquinas’s Fifth Way:

We see that things which lack knowledge, such as natural bodies, act for an end, and this is evident from their acting always, or nearly always, in the same way, so as to obtain the best result. Hence it is plain that they achieve their end, not fortuitously, but designedly. Now whatever lacks knowledge cannot move towards an end, unless it be directed by some being endowed with knowledge and intelligence; as the arrow is directed by the archer. Therefore some intelligent being exists by whom all natural things are directed to their end; and this being we call God (Aquinas, Summa Theologica, Article 3, Question 2).

It is worth noting that Aquinas’s version of the argument relies on a very strong claim about the explanation for ends and processes: the existence of any end-directed system or process can be explained, as a logical matter, only by the existence of an intelligent being who directs that system or process towards its end. Since the operations of all natural bodies, on Aquinas’s view, are directed towards some specific end that conduces to, at the very least, the preservation of the object, these operations can be explained only by the existence of an intelligent being. Accordingly, the empirical fact that the operations of natural objects are directed towards ends shows that an intelligent Deity exists.

This crucial claim, however, seems to be refuted by the mere possibility of an evolutionary explanation. If a Darwinian explanation is even coherent (that is, non-contradictory, as opposed to true), then it provides a logically possible explanation for how the end-directedness of the operations of living beings in this world might have come about. According to this explanation, such operations evolve through a process by which random genetic mutations are naturally selected for their adaptive value; organisms that have evolved some system that performs a fitness-enhancing operation are more likely to survive and leave offspring, other things being equal, than organisms that have not evolved such systems. If this explanation is possibly true, it shows that Aquinas is wrong in thinking that “whatever lacks knowledge cannot move towards an end, unless it be directed by some being endowed with knowledge and intelligence.”

b. The Argument from Simple Analogy

The next important version of the design argument came in the 17th and 18th Centuries. Pursuing a strategy that has been adopted by the contemporary intelligent design movement, John Ray, Richard Bentley, and William Derham drew on scientific discoveries of the 16th and 17th Century to argue for the existence of an intelligent Deity. William Derham, for example, saw evidence of intelligent design in the vision of birds, the drum of the ear, the eye-socket, and the digestive system. Richard Bentley saw evidence of intelligent design in Newton’s discovery of the law of gravitation. It is noteworthy that each of these thinkers attempted to give scientifically-based arguments for the existence of God.

David Hume is the most famous critic of these arguments. In Part II of his famous Dialogues Concerning Natural Religion, Hume formulates the argument as follows:

Look round the world: contemplate the whole and every part of it: you will find it to be nothing but one great machine, subdivided into an infinite number of lesser machines, which again admit of subdivisions to a degree beyond what human senses and faculties can trace and explain. All these various machines, and even their most minute parts, are adjusted to each other with an accuracy which ravishes into admiration all men who have ever contemplated them. The curious adapting of means to ends, throughout all nature, resembles exactly, though it much exceeds, the productions of human contrivance; of human designs, thought, wisdom, and intelligence. Since, therefore, the effects resemble each other, we are led to infer, by all the rules of analogy, that the causes also resemble; and that the Author of Nature is somewhat similar to the mind of man, though possessed of much larger faculties, proportioned to the grandeur of the work which he has executed. By this argument a posteriori, and by this argument alone, do we prove at once the existence of a Deity, and his similarity to human mind and intelligence.

Since the world, on this analysis, is closely analogous to the most intricate artifacts produced by human beings, we can infer “by all the rules of analogy” the existence of an intelligent designer who created the world. Just as the watch has a watchmaker, then, the universe has a universe-maker.

As expressed in this passage, then, the argument is a straightforward argument from analogy with the following structure:

1. The material universe resembles the intelligent productions of human beings in that it exhibits design.
2. The design in any human artifact is the effect of having been made by an intelligent being.
3. Like effects have like causes.
4. Therefore, the design in the material universe is the effect of having been made by an intelligent creator.

Hume criticizes the argument on two main grounds. First, Hume rejects the analogy between the material universe and any particular human artifact. As Hume states the relevant rule of analogy, “wherever you depart in the least, from the similarity of the cases, you diminish proportionably the evidence; and may at last bring it to a very weak analogy, which is confessedly liable to error and uncertainty” (Hume, Dialogues, Part II). Hume then goes on to argue that the cases are simply too dissimilar to support an inference that they are like effects having like causes:

If we see a house,… we conclude, with the greatest certainty, that it had an architect or builder because this is precisely that species of effect which we have experienced to proceed from that species of cause. But surely you will not affirm that the universe bears such a resemblance to a house that we can with the same certainty infer a similar cause, or that the analogy is here entire and perfect (Hume, Dialogues, Part II).

Since the analogy fails, Hume argues that we would need to have experience with the creation of material worlds in order to justify any a posteriori claims about the causes of any particular material world; since we obviously lack such experience, we lack adequate justification for the claim that the material universe has an intelligent cause.

Second, Hume argues that, even if the resemblance between the material universe and human artifacts justified thinking they have similar causes, it would not justify thinking that an all-perfect God exists and created the world. For example, there is nothing in the argument that would warrant the inference that the creator of the universe is perfectly intelligent or perfectly good. Indeed, Hume argues that there is nothing there that would justify thinking even that there is just one deity: “what shadow of an argument… can you produce from your hypothesis to prove the unity of the Deity? A great number of men join in building a house or ship, in rearing a city, in framing a commonwealth; why may not several deities combine in contriving and framing a world” (Hume Dialogues, Part V)?

c. Paley’s Watchmaker Argument

Though often confused with the argument from simple analogy, the watchmaker argument from William Paley is a more sophisticated design argument that attempts to avoid Hume’s objection to the analogy between worlds and artifacts. Instead of simply asserting a similarity between the material world and some human artifact, Paley’s argument proceeds by identifying what he takes to be a reliable indicator of intelligent design:

[S]uppose I found a watch upon the ground, and it should be inquired how the watch happened to be in that place, I should hardly think … that, for anything I knew, the watch might have always been there. Yet why should not this answer serve for the watch as well as for [a] stone [that happened to be lying on the ground]?… For this reason, and for no other; namely, that, if the different parts had been differently shaped from what they are, if a different size from what they are, or placed after any other manner, or in any order than that in which they are placed, either no motion at all would have been carried on in the machine, or none which would have answered the use that is now served by it (Paley 1867, 1).

There are thus two features of a watch that reliably indicate that it is the result of an intelligent design. First, it performs some function that an intelligent agent would regard as valuable; the fact that the watch performs the function of keeping time is something that has value to an intelligent agent. Second, the watch could not perform this function if its parts and mechanisms were differently sized or arranged; the fact that the ability of a watch to keep time depends on the precise shape, size, and arrangement of its parts suggests that the watch has these characteristics because some intelligent agency designed it to these specifications. Taken together, these two characteristics endow the watch with a functional complexity that reliably distinguishes objects that have intelligent designers from objects that do not.

Paley then goes on to argue that the material universe exhibits the same kind of functional complexity as a watch:

Every indicator of contrivance, every manifestation of design, which existed in the watch, exists in the works of nature; with the difference, on the side of nature, of being greater and more, and that in a degree which exceeds all computation. I mean that the contrivances of nature surpass the contrivances of art, in the complexity, subtilty, and curiosity of the mechanism; and still more, if possible, do they go beyond them in number and variety; yet in a multitude of cases, are not less evidently mechanical, not less evidently contrivances, not less evidently accommodated to their end, or suited to their office, than are the most perfect productions of human ingenuity (Paley 1867, 13).

Since the works of nature possess functional complexity, a reliable indicator of intelligent design, we can justifiably conclude that these works were created by an intelligent agent who designed them to instantiate this property.

Paley’s watchmaker argument is clearly not vulnerable to Hume’s criticism that the works of nature and human artifacts are too dissimilar to infer that they are like effects having like causes. Paley’s argument, unlike arguments from analogy, does not depend on a premise asserting a general resemblance between the objects of comparison. What matters for Paley’s argument is that works of nature and human artifacts have a particular property that reliably indicates design. Regardless of how dissimilar any particular natural object might otherwise be from a watch, both objects exhibit the sort of functional complexity that warrants an inference that it was made by an intelligent designer.

Paley’s version of the argument, however, is generally thought to have been refuted by Charles Darwin’s competing explanation for complex organisms. In The Origin of the Species, Darwin argued that more complex biological organisms evolved gradually over millions of years from simpler organisms through a process of natural selection. As Julian Huxley describes the logic of this process:

The evolutionary process results immediately and automatically from the basic property of living matter—that of self-copying, but with occasional errors. Self-copying leads to multiplication and competition; the errors in self-copying are what we call mutations, and mutations will inevitably confer different degrees of biological advantage or disadvantage on their possessors. The consequence will be differential reproduction down the generations—in other words, natural selection (Huxley 1953, 4).

Over time, the replication of genetic material in an organism results in mutations that give rise to new traits in the organism’s offspring. Sometimes these new traits are so unfavorable to a being’s survival prospects that beings with the traits die off; but sometimes these new traits enable the possessors to survive conditions that kill off beings without them. If the trait is sufficiently favorable, only members of the species with the trait will survive. By this natural process, functionally complex organisms gradually evolve over millions of years from primordially simple organisms.

Contemporary biologist, Richard Dawkins (1986), uses a programming problem to show that the logic of the process renders the Darwinian explanation significantly more probable than the design explanation. Dawkins considers two ways in which one might program a computer to generate the following sequence of characters: METHINKS IT IS LIKE A WEASEL. The first program randomly producing a new 28-character sequence each time it is run; since the program starts over each time, it incorporates a “single-step selection process.” The probability of randomly generating the target sequence on any given try is 27²⁸ (that is, 27 characters selected for each of the 28 positions in the sequence), which amounts to about 1 in (10,000 x 1,000,0006). While a computer running eternally would eventually produce the sequence, Dawkins estimates that it would take 1,000,0005 years—which is 1,000,0003 years longer than the universe has existed. As is readily evident, a program that selects numbers by means of such a “single-step selection mechanism” has a very low probability of reaching the target.

The second program incorporates a “cumulative-step selection mechanism.” It begins by randomly generating a 28-character sequence of letters and spaces and then “breeds” from this sequence in the following way. For a specified period of time, it generates copies of itself; most of the copies perfectly replicate the sequence, but some copies have errors (or mutations). At the end of this period, it compares all of the sequences with the target sequence METHINKS IT IS LIKE A WEASEL and keeps the sequence that most closely resembles it. For example, a sequence that has an E in the second place more closely resembles a sequence that is exactly like the first except that it has a Q in the second place. It then begins breeding from this new sequence in exactly the same way. Unlike the first program which starts afresh with each try, the second program builds on previous steps, getting successively closer to the program as it breeds from the sequence closest to the target. This feature of the program increases the probability of reaching the sequence to such an extent that a computer running this program hit the target sequence after 43 generations, which took about half-an-hour.

The problem with Paley’s watchmaker argument, as Dawkins explains it, is that it falsely assumes that all of the other possible competing explanations are sufficiently improbable to warrant an inference of design. While this might be true of explanations that rely entirely on random single-step selection mechanisms, this is not true of Darwinian explanations. As is readily evident from Huxley’s description of the process, Darwinian evolution is a cumulative-step selection method that closely resembles in general structure the second computer program. The result is that the probability of evolving functionally complex organisms capable of surviving a wide variety of conditions is increased to such an extent that it exceeds the probability of the design explanation.

d. Guided Evolution

While many theists are creationists who accept the occurrence of “microevolution” (that is, evolution that occurs within a species, such as the evolution of penicillin-resistant bacteria) but deny the occurrence of “macroevolution” (that is, one species evolving from a distinct species), some theists accept the theory of evolution as consistent with theism and with their own denominational religious commitments. Such thinkers, however, frequently maintain that the existence of God is needed to explain the purposive quality of the evolutionary process. Just as the purposive quality of the cumulative-step computer program above is best explained by intelligent design, so too the purposive quality of natural selection is best explained by intelligent design.

The first theist widely known to have made such an argument is Frederick Robert Tennant. As he puts the matter, in Volume 2 of Philosophical Theology, “the multitude of interwoven adaptations by which the world is constituted a theatre of life, intelligence, and morality, cannot reasonably be regarded as an outcome of mechanism, or of blind formative power, or aught but purposive intelligence” (Tennant 1928-30, 121). In effect, this influential move infers design, not from the existence of functionally complex organisms, but from the purposive quality of the evolutionary process itself. Evolution is, on this line of response, guided by an intelligent Deity.

2. Contemporary Versions of the Design Argument

Contemporary versions of the design argument typically attempt to articulate a more sophisticated strategy for detecting evidence of design in the world. These versions typically contain three main elements—though they are not always explicitly articulated. First, they identify some property P that is thought to be a probabilistically reliable index of design in the following sense: a design explanation for P is significantly more probable than any explanation that relies on chance or random processes. Second they argue that some feature or features of the world exhibits P. Third, they conclude that the design explanation is significantly more likely to be true.

As we will see, however, all of the contemporary versions of the design inference seem to be vulnerable to roughly the same objection. While each of the design inferences in these arguments has legitimate empirical uses, those uses occur only in contexts where we have strong antecedent reason for believing there exist intelligent agents with the ability to bring about the relevant event, entity, or property. But since it is the very existence of such a being that is at issue in the debates about the existence of God, design arguments appear unable to stand by themselves as arguments for God’s existence.

a. The Argument from Irreducible Biochemical Complexity

Design theorists distinguish two types of complexity that can be instantiated by any given structure. As William Dembski describes the distinction: a system or structure is cumulatively complex “if the components of the system can be arranged sequentially so that the successive removal of components never leads to the complete loss of function”; a system or structure is irreducibly complex “if it consists of several interrelated parts so that removing even one part completely destroys the system’s function” (Dembski 1999, 147). A city is cumulatively complex since one can successively remove people, services, and buildings without rendering it unable to perform its function. A mousetrap, in contrast, is irreducibly complex because the removal of even one part results in complete loss of function.

Design proponents, like Michael J. Behe, have identified a number of biochemical systems that they take to be irreducibly complex. Like the functions of a watch or a mousetrap, a cilium cannot perform its function unless its microtubules, nexin linkers, and motor proteins are all arranged and structured in precisely the manner in which they are structured; remove any component from the system and it cannot perform its function. Similarly, the blood-clotting function cannot perform its function if either of its key ingredients, vitamin K and antihemophilic factor, are missing. Both systems are, on this view, irreducibly complex—rather than cumulatively complex.

According to Behe, the probability of evolving irreducibly complex systems along Darwinian lines is sufficiently small that it can be ruled out as an explanation of irreducible biochemical complexity:

An irreducibly complex system cannot be produced … by slight, successive modifications of a precursor system, because any precursor to an irreducibly complex system that is missing a part is by definition nonfunctional…. Since natural selection can only choose systems that are already working, if a biological system cannot be produced gradually it would have to arise as an integrated unit, in one fell swoop, for natural selection to have anything to act on (Behe 1996, 39; emphasis added).

Since, for example, a cilium-precursor (that is, one that lacks at least one of a cilium’s parts) cannot perform the function that endows a cilium with adaptive value, organisms that have the cilium-precursor are no “fitter for survival” than they would have been without it. Since chance-driven evolutionary processes would not select organisms with the precursor, intelligent design is a better explanation for the existence of organisms with fully functional cilia.

Though Behe states his conclusion in categorical terms (that is, irreducibly complex systems “cannot be produced gradually”), he is more charitably construed as claiming only that the probability of gradually producing irreducibly complex systems is very small. The stronger construction of the conclusion (and argument) incorrectly presupposes that Darwinian theory implies that every precursor to a fully functional system must itself perform some function that makes the organism more fit to survive. Organisms that have, say, a precursor to a fully functional cilium are no fitter than they would have been without it, but there is nothing in Darwinian theory that implies they are necessarily any less fit. Thus, there is no reason to think that it is logically or nomologically impossible, according to Darwinian theory, for a set of organisms with a precursor to a fully functional cilium to evolve into a set of organisms that has fully functional cilia. Accordingly, the argument from irreducible biochemical complexity is more plausibly construed as showing that the design explanation for such complexity is more probable than the evolutionary explanation.

Nevertheless, this more modest interpretation is problematic. First, there is little reason to think that the probability of evolving irreducibly complex systems is, as a general matter, small enough to warrant assuming that the probability of the design explanation must be higher. If having a precursor to an irreducibly complex system does not render the organism less fit for survival, the probability a subspecies of organisms with the precursor survives and propagates is the same, other things being equal, as the probability that a subspecies of organisms without the precursor survives and propagates. In such cases, then, the prospect that the subspecies with the precursor will continue to thrive, leave offspring, and evolve is not unusually small.

Second, the claim that intelligent agents of a certain kind would (or should) see functional value in a complex system, by itself, says very little about the probability of any particular causal explanation. While this claim surely implies that intelligent agents with the right causal abilities have a reason for bringing about such systems, it does not tell us anything determinate about whether it is likely that intelligent agents with the right causal powers did bring such systems about—because it does not tell us anything determinate about whether it is probable that such agents exist. As a logical matter, the mere fact that some existing thing has a feature, irreducibly complex or otherwise, that would be valuable to an intelligent being with certain properties, by itself, does not say anything about the probability that such a being exists.

Accordingly, even if we knew that the prospect that the precursor-subspecies would survive was “vanishingly small,” as Behe believes, we would not be justified in inferring a design explanation on probabilistic grounds. To infer that the design explanation is more probable than an explanation of vanishingly small probability, we need some reason to think that the probability of the design explanation is not vanishingly small. The problem, however, is that the claim that a complex system has some property that would be valued by an intelligent agent with the right abilities, by itself, simply does not justify inferring that the probability that such an agent exists and brought about the existence of that system is not vanishingly small. In the absence of some further information about the probability that such an agent exists, we cannot legitimately infer design as the explanation of irreducible biochemical complexity.

b. The Argument from Biological Information

While the argument from irreducible biochemical complexity focuses on the probability of evolving irreducibly complex living systems or organisms from simpler living systems or organisms, the argument from biological information focuses on the problem of generating living organisms in the first place. Darwinian theories are intended only to explain how it is that more complex living organisms developed from primordially simple living organisms, and hence do not even purport to explain the origin of the latter. The argument from biological information is concerned with an explanation of how it is that the world went from a state in which it contained no living organisms to a state in which it contained living organisms; that is to say, it is concerned with the explanation of the very first forms of life.

There are two distinct problems involved in explaining the origin of life from a naturalistic standpoint. The first is to explain how it is that a set of non-organic substances could combine to produce the amino acids that are the building blocks of every living substance. The second is to explain the origin of the information expressed by the sequences of nucleotides that form DNA molecules. The precise ordering of the four nucleotides, adenine, thymine, guanine, and cytosine (A, T, G, and C, for short), determine the specific operations that occur within a living cell and is hence fairly characterized as representing (or embodying) information. As Stephen C. Meyer puts the point: “just as the letters in the alphabet of a written language may convey a particular message depending on their sequence, so too do the sequences of nucleotides or bases in the DNA molecule convey precise biochemical instructions that direct protein synthesis within the cell” (Meyer 1998, 526).

The argument from biological information is concerned with only the second of these problems. In particular, it attempts to evaluate four potential explanations for the origin of biological information: (1) chance; (2) a pre-biotic form of natural selection; (3) chemical necessity; and (4) intelligent design. The argument concludes that intelligent design is the most probable explanation for the information present in large biomacromolecules like DNA, RNA, and proteins.

The argument proceeds as follows. Pre-biotic natural selection and chemical necessity cannot, as a logical matter, explain the origin of biological information. Theories of pre-biotic natural selection are problematic because they illicitly assume the very feature they are trying to explain. These explanations proceed by asserting that the most complex nonliving molecules will reproduce more efficiently than less complex nonliving molecules. But, in doing so, they assume that nonliving chemicals instantiate precisely the kind of replication mechanism that biological information is needed to explain in the case of living organisms. In the absence of some sort of explanation as to how non-organic reproduction could occur, theories of pre-biotic natural selection fail.

Theories of chemical necessity are problematic because chemical necessity can explain, at most, the development of highly repetitive ordered sequences incapable of representing information. Because processes involving chemical necessity are highly regular and predictable in character, they are capable of producing only highly repetitive sequences of “letters.” For example, while chemical necessity could presumably explain a sequence like “ababababababab,” it cannot explain specified but highly irregular sequences like “the house is on fire.” The problem is that highly repetitive sequences like the former are not sufficiently complex and varied to express information. Thus, while chemical necessity can explain periodic order among nucleotide letters, it lacks the resources logically needed to explain the aperiodic, highly specified, complexity of a sequence capable of expressing information.

Ultimately, this leaves only chance and design as logically viable explanations of biological information. Although it is logically possible to obtain functioning sequences of amino acids through purely random processes, some researchers have estimated the probability of doing so under the most favorable of assumptions at approximately 1 in 10⁶⁵. Factoring in more realistic assumptions about pre-biotic conditions, Meyer argues the probability of generating short functional protein is 1 in 10¹²⁵—a number that is vanishingly small. Meyer concludes: “given the complexity of proteins, it is extremely unlikely that a random search through all the possible amino acid sequences could generate even a single relatively short functional protein in the time available since the beginning of the universe (let alone the time available on the early earth)” (Meyer 2002, 75).

Next, Meyer argues that the probability of the design explanation for the origin of biological information is considerably higher:

[O]ne can detect the past action of an intelligent cause from the presence of an information-rich effect, even if the cause itself cannot be directly observed. For instances, visitors to the gardens of Victoria harbor in Canada correctly infer the activity of intelligent agents when they see a pattern of red and yellow flowers spelling “Welcome to Victoria”, even if they did not see the flowers planted and arranged. Similarly, the specifically arranged nucleotide sequences—the complex but functionally specified sequences—in DNA imply the past action of an intelligent mind, even if such mental agency cannot be directly observed (Meyer 2002, 93).

Further, scientists in many fields typically infer the causal activity of intelligent agents from the occurrence of information content. As Meyer rightly observes by way of example, “[a]rcheologists assume a mind produced the inscriptions on the Rosetta Stone” (Meyer 2002, 94).

Meyer’s reasoning appears vulnerable to the same objection to which the argument from biochemical complexity is vulnerable. In all of the contexts in which we legitimately make the design inference in response to an observation of information, we already know that there exist intelligent agents with the right sorts of motivations and abilities to produce information content; after all, we know that human beings exist and are frequently engaged in the production and transmission of information. It is precisely because we have this background knowledge that we can justifiably be confident that intelligent design is a far more probable explanation than chance for any occurrence of information that a human being is capable of producing. In the absence of antecedent reason for thinking there exist intelligent agents capable of creating information content, the occurrence of a pattern of flowers in the shape of “Welcome to Victoria” would not obviously warrant an inference of intelligent design.

The problem, however, is that it is the very existence of an intelligent Deity that is at issue. In the absence of some antecedent reason for thinking there exists an intelligent Deity capable of creating biological information, the occurrence of sequences of nucleotides that can be described as “representing information” does not obviously warrant an inference of intelligent design—no matter how improbable the chance explanation might be. To justify preferring one explanation as more probable than another, we must have information about the probability of each explanation. The mere fact that certain sequences take a certain shape that we can see meaning or value in, by itself, tells us nothing obvious about the probability that it is the result of intelligent design.

It is true, of course, that “experience affirms that information content not only routinely arises but always arises from the activity of intelligent minds” (Meyer 2002, 92), but our experience is limited to the activity of human beings—beings that are frequently engaged in activities that are intended to produce information content. While that experience will inductively justify inferring that some human agency is the cause of any information that could be explained by human beings, it will not inductively justify inferring the existence of an intelligent agency with causal powers that depart as radically from our experience as the powers that are traditionally attributed to God. The argument from biological information, like the argument from biochemical complexity, seems incapable of standing alone as an argument for God’s existence.

c. The Fine-Tuning Arguments

Scientists have determined that life in the universe would not be possible if more than about two dozen properties of the universe were even slightly different from what they are; as the matter is commonly put, the universe appears “fine-tuned” for life. For example, life would not be possible if the force of the big bang explosion had differed by one part in 10⁶⁰; the universe would have either collapsed on itself or expanded too rapidly for stars to form. Similarly, life would not be possible if the force binding protons to neutrons differed by even five percent.

It is immediately tempting to think that the probability of a fine-tuned universe is so small that intelligent design simply must be the more probable explanation. The supposition that it is a matter of chance that so many things could be exactly what they need to be for life to exist in the universe just seems implausibly improbable. Since, on this intuition, the only two explanations for the highly improbable appearance of fine-tuning are chance and an intelligent agent who deliberately designed the universe to be hospitable to life, the latter simply has to be the better explanation.

This natural line of argument is vulnerable to a cogent objection. The mere fact that it is enormously improbable that an event occurred by chance, by itself, gives us no reason to think that it occurred by design. Suppose we flip a fair coin 1000 times and record the results in succession. The probability of getting the particular outcome is vanishingly small: 1 in 2¹⁰⁰⁰ to be precise. But it is clear that the mere fact that such a sequence is so improbable, by itself, does not give us any reason to think that it was the result of intelligent design. As intuitively tempting as it may be to conclude from just the apparent improbability of a fine-tuned universe that it is the result of divine agency, the inference is unsound.

i. The Argument from Suspicious Improbabilitys

George N. Schlesinger, however, attempts to formalize the fine-tuning intuition in a way that avoids this objection. To understand Schlesinger’s argument, consider your reaction to two different events. If John wins a 1-in-1,000,000,000 lottery game, you would not immediately be tempted to think that John (or someone acting on his behalf) cheated. If, however, John won three consecutive 1-in-1,000 lotteries, you would immediately be tempted to think that John (or someone acting on his behalf) cheated. Schlesinger believes that the intuitive reaction to these two scenarios is epistemically justified. The structure of the latter event is such that it is justifies a belief that intelligent design is the cause: the fact that John got lucky in three consecutive lotteries is a reliable indicator that his winning was the intended result of someone’s intelligent agency. Despite the fact that the probability of winning three consecutive 1-in-1,000 games is exactly the same as the probability of winning one 1-in-1,000,000,000 game, the former event is of a kind that is surprising in a way that warrants an inference of intelligent design.

Schlesinger argues that the fact that the universe is fine-tuned for life is improbable in exactly the same way that John’s winning three consecutive lotteries is improbable. After all, it is not just that we got lucky with respect to one property-lottery game; we got lucky with respect to two dozen property-lottery games—lotteries that we had to win in order for there to be life in the universe. Given that we are justified in inferring intelligent design in the case of John’s winning three consecutive lotteries, we are even more justified in inferring intelligent design in the case of our winning two dozen much more improbable property lotteries. Thus, Schlesinger concludes, the most probable explanation for the remarkable fact that the universe has exactly the right properties to sustain life is that an intelligent Deity intentionally created the universe such as to sustain life.

This argument is vulnerable to a number of criticisms. First, while it might be clear that carbon-based life would not be possible if the universe were slightly different with respect to these two-dozen fine-tuned properties, it is not clear that no form of life would be possible. Second, some physicists speculate that this physical universe is but one material universe in a “multiverse” in which all possible material universes are ultimately realized. If this highly speculative hypothesis is correct, then there is nothing particularly suspicious about the fact that there is a fine-tuned universe, since the existence of such a universe is inevitable (that is, has probability 1) if all every material universe is eventually realized in the multiverse. Since some universe, so to speak, had to win, the fact that ours won does not demand any special explanation.

Schlesinger’s fine-tuning argument also appears vulnerable to the same criticism as the other versions of the design argument (see Himma 2002). While Schlesinger is undoubtedly correct in thinking that we are justified in suspecting design in the case where John wins three consecutive lotteries, it is because—and only because—we know two related empirical facts about such events. First, we already know that there exist intelligent agents who have the right motivations and causal abilities to deliberately bring about such events. Second, we know from past experience with such events that they are usually explained by the deliberate agency of one or more of these agents. Without at least one of these two pieces of information, we are not obviously justified in seeing design in such cases.

As before, the problem for the fine-tuning argument is that we lack both of the pieces that are needed to justify an inference of design. First, the very point of the argument is to establish the fact that there exists an intelligent agency that has the right causal abilities and motivations to bring the existence of a universe capable of sustaining life. Second, and more obviously, we do not have any past experience with the genesis of worlds and are hence not in a position to know whether the existence of fine-tuned universes are usually explained by the deliberate agency of some intelligent agency. Because we lack this essential background information, we are not justified in inferring that there exists an intelligent Deity who deliberately created a universe capable of sustaining life.

ii. The Confirmatory Argument

Robin Collins defends a more modest version of the fine-tuning argument that relies on a general principle of confirmation theory, rather than a principle that is contrived to distinguish events or entities that are explained by intelligent design from events or entities explained by other factors. Collins’s version of the argument relies on what he calls the Prime Principle of Confirmation: If observation O is more probable under hypothesis H1 than under hypothesis H2, then O provides a reason for preferring H1 over H2. The idea is that the fact that an observation is more likely under the assumption that H1 is true than under the assumption H2 is true counts as evidence in favor of H1.

This version of the fine-tuning argument proceeds by comparing the relative likelihood of a fine-tuned universe under two hypotheses:

1. The Design Hypothesis: there exists a God who created the universe such as to sustain life;
2. The Atheistic Single-Universe Hypothesis: there exists one material universe, and it is a matter of chance that the universe has the fine-tuned properties needed to sustain life.

Assuming the Design Hypothesis is true, the probability that the universe has the fine-tuned properties approaches (if it does not equal) 1. Assuming the Atheistic Single-Universe Hypothesis is true, the probability that the universe has the fine-tuned properties is very small—though it is not clear exactly how small. Applying the Prime Principle of Confirmation, Collins concludes that the observation of fine-tuned properties provides reason for preferring the Design Hypothesis over the Atheistic Single-Universe Hypothesis.

At the outset, it is crucial to note that Collins does not intend the fine-tuned argument as a proof of God’s existence. As he explains, the Prime Principle of Confirmation “is a general principle of reasoning which tells us when some observation counts as evidence in favor of one hypothesis over another” (Collins 1999, 51). Indeed, he explicitly acknowledges that “the argument does not say that the fine-tuning evidence proves that the universe was designed, or even that it is likely that the universe was designed” (Collins 1999, 53). It tells us only that the observation of fine-tuning provides one reason for accepting the Theistic Hypothesis over the Atheistic Single-Universe Hypothesis—and one that can be rebutted by other evidence.

The confirmatory version of the fine-tuning argument is not vulnerable to the objection that it relies on an inference strategy that presupposes that we have independent evidence for thinking the right kind of intelligent agency exists. As a general scientific principle, the Prime Principle of Confirmation can be applied in a wide variety of circumstances and is not limited to circumstances in which we have other reasons to believe the relevant conclusion is true. If the observation of a fine-tuned universe is more probable under the Theistic Hypothesis than under the Atheistic Single-Universe Hypothesis, then this fact is a reason for preferring the Design Hypothesis to Atheistic Single-Universe Hypothesis.

Nevertheless, the confirmatory version of the argument is vulnerable on other fronts. As a first step towards seeing one worry, consider two possible explanations for the observation that John Doe wins a 1-in-7,000,000 lottery (see Himma 2002). According to the Theistic Lottery Hypothesis, God wanted John Doe to win and deliberately brought it about that his numbers were drawn. According to the Chance Lottery Hypothesis, John Doe’s numbers were drawn by chance. It is clear that John’s winning the lottery is vastly more probable under the Theistic Lottery Hypothesis than under the Chance Lottery Hypothesis. By the Prime Principle of Confirmation, then, John’s winning the lottery provides a reason to prefer the Theistic Lottery Hypothesis over the Chance Lottery Hypothesis.

As is readily evident, the above reasoning, by itself, provides very weak support for the Theistic Lottery Hypothesis. If all we know about the world is that John Doe won a lottery and the only possible explanations for this observation are the Theistic Lottery Hypothesis and the Chance Lottery Hypothesis, then this observation provides some reason to prefer the former. But it does not take much counterevidence to rebut the Theistic Lottery Hypothesis: a single observation of a lottery that relies on a random selection process will suffice. A single application of the Prime Principle of Confirmation, by itself, is simply not designed to provide the sort of reason that would warrant much confidence in preferring one hypothesis to another.

For this reason, the confirmatory version of the fine-tuning argument, by itself, provides a weak reason for preferring the Design Hypothesis over the Atheistic Single Universe Hypothesis. Although Collins is certainly correct in thinking the observation of fine-tuning provides a reason for accepting the Design Hypothesis and hence rational ground for belief that God exists, that reason is simply not strong enough to do much in the way of changing the minds of either agnostics or atheists.

3. The Scientifically Legitimate Uses of Design Inferences

It is worth noting that proponents are correct in thinking that design inferences have a variety of legitimate scientific uses. Such inferences are used to detect intelligent agency in a large variety of contexts, including criminal and insurance investigations. Consider, for example, the notorious case of Nicholas Caputo. Caputo, a member of the Democratic Party, was a public official responsible for conducting drawings to determine the relative ballot positions of Democrats and Republicans. During Caputo’s tenure, the Democrats drew the top ballot position 40 of 41 times, making it far more likely that an undecided voter would vote for the Democratic candidate than for the Republican candidate. The Republican Party filed suit against Caputo, arguing he deliberately rigged the ballot to favor his own party. After noting that the probability of picking the Democrats 40 out of 41 times was less than 1 in 50 billion, the court legitimately made a design inference, concluding that “few persons of reason will accept the explanation of blind chance.”

What proponents of design arguments for God’s existence, however, have not noticed is that each one of these indubitably legitimate uses occurs in a context in which we are already justified in thinking that intelligent beings with the right motivations and abilities exist. In every context in which design inferences are routinely made by scientists, they already have conclusive independent reason for believing there exist intelligent agents with the right abilities and motivations to bring about the apparent instance of design.

Consider, for example, how much more information was available to the court in the Caputo case than is available to the proponent of the design argument for God’s existence. Like the proponent of the design argument, the court knew that (1) the relevant event or feature is something that might be valued by an intelligent agent; and (2) the odds of it coming about by chance are astronomically small. Unlike the proponent of the design argument, however, the court had an additional piece of information available to it: the court already knew that there existed an intelligent agent with the right causal abilities and motives to bring about the event; after all, there was no dispute whatsoever about the existence of Caputo. It was that piece of information, together with (1), that enabled the court to justifiably conclude that the probability that an intelligent agent deliberately brought it about that the Democrats received the top ballot position 40 of 41 times was significantly higher than the probability that this happened by chance. Without this crucial piece of information, however, the court would not have been so obviously justified in making the design inference. Accordingly, while the court was right to infer a design explanation in the Caputo case, this is, in part, because the judges already knew that the right kind of intelligent beings exist—and one of them happened to have occupied a position that afforded him with the opportunity to rig the drawings in favor of the Democrats.

In response, one might be tempted to argue that there is one context in which scientists employ the design inference without already having sufficient reason to think the right sort of intelligent agency exists. As is well-known, researchers monitor radio transmissions for patterns that would support a design inference that such transmissions are sent by intelligent beings. For example, it would be reasonable to infer that some intelligent extraterrestrial beings were responsible for a transmission of discrete signals and pauses that effectively enumerated the prime numbers from 2 to 101. In this case, the intelligibility of the pattern, together with the improbability of its occurring randomly, seems to justify the inference that the transmission sequence is the result of intelligent design.

As it turns out, we are already justified in thinking that the right sort of intelligent beings exist even in this case. We already know, after all, that we exist and have the right sort of motivations and abilities to bring about such transmissions because we send them into space hoping that some other life form will detect our existence. While our existence in the universe—and this is crucial—does not, by itself, justify thinking that there are other intelligent life forms in the universe, it does justify thinking that the probability that there are such life forms is higher than the astronomically small probability (1 in 2¹¹³⁶ to be precise) that a sequence of discrete radio signals and pauses that enumerates the prime numbers from 2 to 101 is the result of chance. Thus, we would be justified in inferring design as the explanation of such a sequence on the strength of three facts: (1) the probability of such a chance occurrence is 1 in 2¹¹³⁶; (2) there exist intelligent beings in the universe capable of bringing about such an occurrence; and (3) the sequence of discrete signals and pauses has a special significance to intelligent beings. In particular, (2) and (3) tell us that the probability that design explains such an occurrence is significantly higher than 1 in 2¹¹³⁶—though it is not clear exactly what the probability is.

Insofar as the legitimate application of design inferences presupposes that we have antecedent reason to believe the right kind of intelligent being exists, they can enable us to distinguish what such beings do from what merely happens. If we already know, for example, that there exist beings capable of rigging a lottery, then design inferences can enable us to distinguish lottery results that merely happen from lottery results that are deliberately brought about by such agents. Similarly, if we already have adequate reason to believe that God exists, then design inferences can enable us to distinguish features of the world that merely happen from features of the world that are deliberately brought about by the agency of God. Indeed, to the extent that we are antecedently justified in believing that God exists, it is obviously more reasonable to believe that God deliberately structured the universe to have the fine-tuned properties than it is to believe that somehow this occurred by chance.

If this is correct, then design inferences simply cannot do the job they are asked to do in design arguments for God’s existence. Insofar as they presuppose that we already know the right kind of intelligent being exists, they cannot stand alone as a justification for believing that God exists. It is the very existence of the right kind of intelligent being that is at issue in the dispute over whether God exists. While design inferences have a variety of scientifically legitimate uses, they cannot stand alone as arguments for God’s existence.

4. References and Further Reading

• Michael J. Behe, Darwin’s Black Box: The Biochemical Challenge to Evolution (New York: Touchstone Books, 1996)
• Richard Bentley, A Confutation of Atheism from the Origin and Frame of the World (London: H. Mortlock, 1692-1693)
• Robin Collins, “A Scientific Argument for the Existence of God,” in Michael J. Murray (ed.), Reason for the Hope Within (Grand Rapids, MI: William B. Eerdmans Publishing Co., 1999)
• Charles Darwin, The Origin of Species, Everyman’s Library (London: J.M. Dent, 1947)
• Richard Dawkins, The Blind Watchmaker: Why the Evidence of Evolution Reveals a Universe without Design (New York: Norton Publishing, 1996; originally published in 1986)
• William Dembski, The Design Inference (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1998)
• William Dembski, No Free Lunch: Why Specified Complexity Cannot Be Purchased without Intelligence (Rowman & Littlefield, 2002)
• William Derham, Physico-theology, or, A Demonstration of the Being and Attributes of God from his Works of Creation Being the Substance of XVI Sermons Preached in St. Mary le Bow-Church, London, at the Hon’ble Mr. Boyle’s Lectures in the Years 1711 and 1712 (London: W. Innys, 1713)
• William Derham, Astro-theology, or, A Demonstration of the Being and Attributes of God: From a Survey of the Heavens (London: W. Innys, 1715)
• Kenneth Einar Himma, “Prior Probabilities and Confirmation Theory: A Problem with the Fine-Tuning Argument,” International Journal for Philosophy of Religion, vol. 51, no. 4 (June 2002)
• Kenneth Einar Himma, “The Application-Conditions for Design Inferences: Why the Design Arguments Need the Help of Other Arguments for God’s Existence,”International Journal for Philosophy of Religion., vol. 57, no. 1 (February 2005).
• David Hume, Dialogues Concerning Natural Religion, edited with an introduction by Norman Kemp Smith, (New York: Social Sciences Publishers, 1948)
• Julian Huxley, Evolution as Process (New York: Harper and Row, 1953).
• Stephen C. Meyer, “DNA by Design: An Inference to the Best Explanation,” Rhetoric and Public Affairs, vol. 1, no. 4 (Winter 1998)
• Stephen C. Meyer, “Evidence for Design in Physics and Biology: From the Origin of the Universe to the Origin of Life,” in Behe, Dembski, and Meyer (eds.), Science and Evidence for Design in the Universe (San Francisco: Ignatius Press, 2002)
• William Paley, Natural Theology: Or Evidences of the Existence and Attributes of the Deity Collected from the Appearances of Nature (Boston: Gould and Lincoln, 1867)
• Del Ratzsch, Nature, Design, and Science: The Status of Design in Natural Science (Albany, NY: SUNY Press, 2001)
• John Ray, The Wisdom of God Manifested in the Works of the Creation Being the Substance of Some Common Places Delivered in the Chappel of Trinity-College, in Cambridge (London: Printed for Samuel Smith, 1691)
• Hugh Ross, Beyond the Cosmos: What Recent Discoveries in Astronomy and Physics Reveal about the Nature of God (Colorado Springs: Nav Press, 1996)
• George N. Schlesinger, New Perspectives on Old-time Religion (Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1988)
• Frederick Robert Tennant, Philosophical Theology, Volume 2 (1928-30)

Author Information

Kenneth Einar Himma
Email: himma@spu.edu
Seattle Pacific University
U. S. A.

Miracles

The term “miracle” is used very broadly in ordinary language. A quick review of news stories may turn up reports such as that of a “Christmas Miracle,” by which the Texas gulf coast came to be blanketed with snow by a rare storm. We speak of miracle drugs, or of miracle babies, and some household products purport to be miraculous as well. Philosophical discussion of the miraculous, however, is confined to the use to which religion—and in particular, theistic religion—puts that conception. These philosophical discussions center around two overlapping issues.

The first of these issues is a conceptual one: What is a miracle? Controversy over the conception of a miracle focuses primarily on whether a miracle must be, in some sense, contrary to natural law. Must it, in particular, be a violation of natural law? Supposing that it must be, a second question arises, namely, whether the conception of such a violation is a coherent one.

Philosophers have also been concerned about what sort of observable criteria would allow us to identify an event as a miracle, particularly insofar as that means identifying it as a violation of natural law. How, for example, can we tell the difference between a case in which an event is a genuine violation—assuming that some sense can be made of this notion—and one that conforms to some natural law that is unknown to us? And given the occurrence of a genuine violation, how are we to determine whether it is due to divine agency, or whether it is nothing more than a spontaneous lapse in the natural order?

The second main issue is epistemological: Once we settle on what a miracle is, can we ever have good reason to believe that one has taken place? This question is generally connected with the problem of whether testimony, such as that provided by scriptural sources, can ever give us adequate reason to believe that a miracle has occurred.

Table of Contents

1. The Definition of “Miracle”
2. Miracles and Worldview
3. The Credibility of Witnesses
4. Hume’s Argument
5. Problems With Hume’s Argument
   1. Does Hume’s Argument Beg the Question?
6. Conceptual Difficulties I: The Logical Impossibility of a Violation
   1. Violations as Nonrepeatable Counterinstances to Natural Law
   2. Miracles as Outside the Scope of Natural Laws
7. Conceptual Difficulties II: Identifying Miracles
8. Supernatural Causes, Supernatural Explanation
9. Coincidence Miracles
10. Miracle as Basic Action
11. Wittgenstein: Miracle as Gesture
12. References and Further Reading

1. The Definition of “Miracle”

In sketching out a brief philosophical discussion of miracles, it would be desirable to begin with a definition of “miracle;” unfortunately, part of the controversy in regard to miracles is over just what is involved in a proper conception of the miraculous. As a rough beginning, however, we might observe that the term is from the Latin miraculum, which is derived from mirari, to wonder; thus the most general characterization of a miracle is as an event that provokes wonder. As such, it must be in some way extraordinary, unusual, or contrary to our expectations. Disagreement arises, however, as to what makes a miracle something worth wondering about. In what sense must a miracle be extraordinary? One of the earliest accounts is given by St. Augustine, who held (City of God, XXI.8.2) that a miracle is not contrary to nature, but only to our knowledge of nature; miracles are made possible by hidden potentialities in nature that are placed there by God. In Summa Contra Gentiles III:101, St. Thomas Aquinas, expanding upon Augustine’s conception, said that a miracle must go beyond the order usually observed in nature, though he insisted that a miracle is not contrary to nature in any absolute sense, since it is in the nature of all created things to be responsive to God’s will.

In his Enquiry Concerning Human Understanding, David Hume offered two definitions of “miracle;” first, as a violation of natural law (Enquiries p. 114); shortly afterward he offers a more complex definition when he says that a miracle is “a transgression of a law of nature by a particular volition of the Deity, or by the interposition of some invisible agent” (Enquiries, p. 115n). This second definition offers two important criteria that an event must satisfy in order to qualify as a miracle: It must be a violation of natural law, but this by itself is not enough; a miracle must also be an expression of the divine will. This means that a miracle must express divine agency; if we have no reason to think that an event is something done by God, we will have no reason to call it a miracle.

More recently, the idea that a miracle must be defined in terms of natural law has come under attack. R.F. Holland (1965) has argued that a miracle may be consistent with natural law, since a religiously significant coincidence may qualify as miraculous, even though we fully understand the causes that brought it about. Accounts of the miraculous that distance themselves from the requirement that a miracle be in some way contrary to the order of nature, in favor of a focus on their significance to human life, might be said to emphasize their nature as signs; indeed the term semeion, “sign,” is one of the terms used in the New Testament to describe miraculous events.

2. Miracles and Worldview

The outcome of any discussion of miracles seems to depend greatly on our worldview. The usual theistic view of the world is one that presumes the existence of an omnipotent God who, while transcending nature, is nevertheless able to act, or to express his will, within the natural world. Clearly belief in miracles is already plausible if our enquiry may presume this view of things.

The usual way of making this out might be described as supernaturalistic. Those who would defend supernaturalism sometimes do this through a commitment to an ontology of entities that exist in some sense outside of nature, where by “nature” is meant the totality of things that can be known by means of observation and experiment, or more generally, through the methods proper to the natural sciences.

Defenses of supernaturalism may also take a methodological turn by insisting that the natural sciences are incapable of revealing the totality of all that there is. While supernaturalists typically hold that God reveals his nature in part through observable phenomena (as for example in miracles, or more generally, in the order of nature), as we shall understand it here, methodological supernaturalism is committed as well to the view that our knowledge of God must be supplemented by revelation. Revelatory sources for our knowledge of God might, for example, include some form of a priori knowledge, supersensory religious experience, or a direct communication by God of information that would not otherwise be available to us. Knowledge of God that is passed down in scripture, such as the Bible or the Qur’an, is generally conceived by theists to have a revelatory character.

Supernaturalistic accounts of the miraculous very commonly make reference to supernatural causes, which are thought to play a useful role in the construction of supernatural explanations. However, as we will see in sections 10 and 11, belief in miracles does not obviously commit one to belief in supernatural causes or the efficacy of supernatural explanations.

In contrast to supernaturalism, ontological naturalism denies the existence of anything beyond nature; methodological naturalism holds that observation and experiment—or generally speaking, the methods of the empirical sciences—are sufficient to provide us with all of the knowledge that it is possible for us to have. Naturalism is sometimes further characterized as holding that nature is uniform, which is to say that all events in nature conform to generalizations (e.g. laws) which can be verified by means of observation. Naturalists do commonly hold this view—confidence in the uniformity of nature is an important part of the scientific enterprise—but strictly speaking this represents an additional metaphysical commitment regarding the nature of the universe and its susceptibility to human understanding. If nature turns out not to be fully lawlike, this would not require the rejection of naturalism. A failure of uniformity, or what a believer in miracles might refer to as a violation of natural law, would imply only that there are limits to our ability to understand and predict natural phenomena. However, the naturalist is committed to denying the legitimacy of any attempt to explain a natural phenomenon by appeal to the supernatural. Naturalism denies the existence of supernatural entities and denies as well the claim that revelation is capable of providing us with genuine knowledge. Where the supernaturalistic worldview is quite open to the possibility of miracles, naturalism is much less sympathetic, and one might argue that the tenets of naturalism rule out the possibility of miracles altogether; see Lewis (1947:Ch. 1), Martin (1992:192) and Davis (1999:131).

Much, of course, depends on how we conceive of miracles, and on what we take their significance to be. One concern we might have with the miraculous would be an apologetic one. By “apologetic” here is meant a defense of the rationality of belief in God. Historically, apologists have pointed to the occurrence of miracles as evidence for theism, which is to say that they have held that scriptural reports of miracles, such as those given in the Bible, provide grounds for belief in God. While this argument is not as popular now as it was in the 18th century, the modern conception of the miraculous has been strongly influenced by this apologetic interest. Such an interest puts important constraints on an account of miracles. If we wish to point to a miracle as supporting belief in a supernatural deity, obviously we cannot begin by assuming the supernaturalistic worldview; this would beg the question. If we are trying to persuade a skeptic of God’s existence, we are trying to demonstrate to him that there is something beyond or transcending nature, and he will demand to be persuaded on his own terms; we must make use of no assumptions beyond those that are already acknowledged by the naturalistic worldview.

Because the history of modern thought regarding miracles has been strongly influenced by apologetic interests, the emphasis of this entry will be on the apologetic conception of the miraculous—that is, on the concept of miracle as it has been invoked by those who would point to the reports of miracles in scripture as establishing the existence of a supernatural God. It is important to bear in mind, however, that any difficulty associated with this apologetic appeal to miracles does not automatically militate against the reasonableness of belief in miracles generally. A successful criticism of the apologetic appeal will show at most that a warranted belief in miracles depends on our having independent reasons for rejecting naturalism; again, see Lewis (1947:11).

3. The Credibility of Witnesses

A major concern with the rationality of belief in miracles is with whether we can be justified in believing that a miracle has occurred on the basis of testimony. To determine whether the report of a miracle is credible, we need to consider the reliability of the source. Suppose subject S reports some state of affairs (or event) E. Are S’s reports generally true? Clearly if she is known to lie, or to utter falsehoods as jokes, we should be reluctant to believe her. Also, if she has any special interest in getting us to believe that E has occurred—if, for example, she stands to benefit financially—this would give us reason for skepticism. It is also possible that S may be reporting a falsehood without intending to do so; she may sincerely believe that E occurred even though it did not, or her report may be subject to unconscious exaggeration or distortion. Aside from the possibility that she may be influenced by some tangible self-interest, such as a financial one, her report may also be influenced by emotional factors—by her fears, perhaps, or by wishful thinking. We should also consider whether other reliable and independent witnesses are available to corroborate her report.

We must also ask whether S is herself a witness to E, or is passing on information that was reported to her. If she witnessed the event personally, we may ask a number of questions about her observational powers and the physical circumstances of her observation. There are quite a few things that can go wrong here; for example, S may sincerely report an event as she believed it to occur, but in fact her report is based on a misperception. Thus she may report having seen a man walk across the surface of a lake; this may be her understanding of what happened, when in fact he was walking alongside the lake or on a sand bar. If it was dark, and the weather was bad, this would have made it difficult for S to have a good view of what was happening. And of course we should not neglect the influence of S’s own attitudes on how she interprets what she sees; if she is already inclined to think of the man she reports as walking on water as being someone who is capable of performing such an extraordinary feat, this may color how she understands what she has seen. By the same token, if we are already inclined to agree with her about this person’s remarkable abilities, we will be all the more likely to believe her report.

If S is merely passing on the testimony of someone else to the occurrence of E, we may question whether she has properly understood what she was told. She may not be repeating the testimony exactly as it was given to her. And here, too, her own biases may color her understanding of the report. The possibility of distortions entering into testimony grows with each re-telling of the story.

It will be fruitful to consider these elements in evaluating the strength of scriptural testimony to the miracles ascribed to Jesus. The reports of these miracles come from the four gospel accounts. Some of these accounts seem to have borrowed from others, or to have been influenced by a common source; even if this were not the case, they still cannot be claimed to represent independent reports. Assuming they originate with the firsthand testimony of Jesus’ followers, these people were closely associated and had the opportunity to discuss among themselves what they had seen before their stories were recorded for posterity. They were all members of the same religious community, and shared a common perspective as well as common interests. While the gospel accounts tell us that miracles took place in front of hostile witnesses, we do not have the testimony of these witnesses. (Later acknowledgments of Jesus’ miracles by hostile parties is, the skeptic will argue, evidence only for the gullibility of these writers.)

It is sometimes suggested that these men undertook grave risk by reporting what they did, and they would not have risked their lives for a lie. But this establishes, at best, only that their reports are sincere; unfortunately, their conviction is not conclusive evidence for the truth of their testimony. We could expect the same conviction from someone who was delusional.

Let us consider a particular report of Jesus’ resurrection in applying these considerations. Popular apologetic sometimes points to the fact that according to Paul in 1 Corinthians (15:6), the resurrected Jesus was seen by five hundred people at once, and that it is highly improbable that so many people would have the experience of seeing Jesus if Jesus were not actually there. After all, it may be argued, they could not have shared a mass hallucination, since hallucinations are typically private; there is no precedent for shared hallucination, and it may seem particularly far-fetched to suppose that a hallucination would be shared among so many people. Accordingly it may be thought much more likely that Jesus really was there and, assuming there is sufficient evidence that he had died previously to that time, it becomes reasonable to say that he was resurrected from the dead.

While this report is sometimes taken as evidence of Jesus’ physical resurrection, Paul says only that he appeared to the five hundred without saying explicitly that it was a physically reconstituted Jesus that these people saw. But let us suppose that Paul means to report that the five hundred saw Jesus in the flesh. Unfortunately we do not have the reports of the five hundred to Jesus’ resurrection; we have only Paul’s hearsay testimony that Jesus was seen by five hundred. Furthermore Paul does not tell us how this information came to him. It is possible that he spoke personally to some or all of these five hundred witnesses, but it is also possible that he is repeating testimony that he received from someone else. This opens up the possibility that the report was distorted before it reached Paul; for example, the number of witnesses may have been exaggerated, or the original witnesses may have merely reported feeling Jesus’ presence in some way without actually seeing him. For the sake of argument, however, let us suppose that there was at one time a group of five hundred people who were all prepared to testify that they had seen a physically resurrected Jesus. This need not be the result of any supposed mass hallucination; the five hundred might have all seen someone who they came to believe, after discussing it amongst themselves, was Jesus. In such a case, the testimony of the five hundred would be to an experience together with a shared interpretation of it.

It is also possible that the text of Paul’s letter to the Corinthians has not been accurately preserved. Thus, no matter how reliable Paul himself might be, his own report may have been modified through one, or several, redactions.

There are, therefore, quite a few points at which error or distortion might have entered into the report in 1 Corinthians: (1) The original witnesses may have been wrong, for one reason or another, about whether they saw Jesus; (2) the testimony of these witnesses may have been distorted before reaching Paul; (3) Paul may have incorrectly reported what he heard about the event, and (4) Paul’s own report, as given in his original letter to the Christian community in Corinth, may have been distorted. The apologist may argue that it would be very surprising if errors should creep into the report at any of these four points. The question we must ask now, however, is which of these alternatives would be more surprising: That some error should arise in regard to 1-4 above, or that Jesus really was resurrected from the dead.

4. Hume’s Argument

In Section X of his Enquiry Concerning Human Understanding, Hume tells us that it is not reasonable to subscribe to any “system of religion” unless that system is validated by the occurrence of miracles; he then argues that we cannot be justified in believing that a miracle has occurred, at least when our belief is based on testimony—as when, for example, it is based on the reports of miracles that are given in scripture. (Hume did not explicitly address the question of whether actually witnessing an apparent miracle would give us good reason to think that a miracle had actually occurred, though it is possible that the principles he invokes in regard to testimony for the miraculous can be applied to the case of a witnessed miracle.) His stated aim is to show that belief in miracle reports is not rational, but that “our most holy religion is founded on Faith, not on reason” (Enquiries, p. 130). Hume surely intends some irony here, however, since he concludes by saying that anyone who embraces a belief in miracles based on faith is conscious of “a continued miracle in his own person, which subverts all the principles of his understanding” (Enquiries, p. 131); this seems very far from an endorsement of a faith-based belief in miracles.

There is some dispute as to the nature of Hume’s argument against miracles, and the Enquiry seems to contain more than one such argument. The most compelling of these is the one I will call the Balance of Probabilities Argument. (For a brief discussion of some of the other arguments, see the entry “David Hume: Writings on Religion.”) Hume tells us that we ought to proportion our certainty regarding any matter of fact to the strength of the evidence. We have already examined some of the considerations that go into assessing the strength of testimony; there is no denying that testimony may be very strong indeed when, for example, it may be given by numerous highly reliable and independent witnesses.

Nevertheless, Hume tells us that no testimony can be adequate to establish the occurrence of a miracle. The problem that arises is not so much with the reliability of the witnesses as with the nature of what is being reported. A miracle is, according to Hume, a violation of natural law. We suppose that a law of nature obtains only when we have an extensive, and exceptionless, experience of a certain kind of phenomenon. For example, we suppose that it is a matter of natural law that a human being cannot walk on the surface of water while it is in its liquid state; this supposition is based on the weight of an enormous body of experience gained from our familiarity with what happens in seas, lakes, kitchen sinks, and bathtubs. Given that experience, we always have the best possible evidence that in any particular case, an object with a sufficiently great average density, having been placed onto the surface of a body of water, will sink. According to Hume, the evidence in favor of a miracle, even when that is provided by the strongest possible testimony, will always be outweighed by the evidence for the law of nature which is supposed to have been violated.

Considerable controversy surrounds the notion of a violation of natural law. However, it would appear that all Hume needs in order to make his argument is that a miracle be an exception to the course of nature as we have previously observed it; that is, where we have had a substantial experience of a certain sort of phenomenon—call it A—and have an exceptionless experience of all As being B, we have very strong reason to believe that any given A will be a B. Thus given that we have a very great amount of experience regarding dense objects being placed onto water, and given that in every one of these cases that object has sunk, we have the strongest possible evidence that any object that is placed onto water is one that will sink. Accordingly we have the best possible reasons for thinking that any report of someone walking on water is false—and this no matter how reliable the witness.

While objections are frequently made against Hume’s conception of natural law, in fact no particularly sophisticated account of natural law seems to be necessary here, and Hume’s examples are quite commonsensical: All human beings must die, lead cannot remain suspended in the air, fire consumes wood and is extinguished by water (Enquiries p. 114). This may be a naive conception of natural law; nevertheless it is true that, all things being equal, we can assign a minimal probability to the occurrence of a counterinstance to any of these generalizations.

At times Hume sounds as though he thinks the probability of such an event is zero, given its unprecedented nature, and some commentators have objected that the fact that we have never known such an event to occur does not imply that it cannot occur. Past regularities do not establish that it is impossible that a natural law should ever be suspended (Purtill 1978). However, regardless of Hume’s original intent, this is a more extravagant claim than his argument requires. He is free to admit that some small probability may be attached to the prospect that a dense object might remain on the surface of a lake; it is sufficient for his purposes that it will always be more likely that any witness who reports such an event is attempting to deceive us, or is himself deceived. After all, there is no precedent for any human being walking on water, setting this one controversial case aside, but there is ample precedent for the falsehood of testimony even under the best of circumstances.

Accordingly Hume says (Enquiries p. 115ff) that “no testimony is sufficient to establish a miracle, unless the testimony be of such a kind, that its falsehood would be more miraculous, than the fact, which it endeavors to establish.” We must always decide in favor of the lesser miracle. We must ask ourselves, which would be more of a miracle: That Jesus walked on water, or that the scriptural reports of this event are false? While we may occasionally encounter testimony that is so strong that its falsehood would be very surprising indeed, we never come across any report, the falsehood of which would be downright miraculous. Accordingly, the reasonable conclusion will always be that the testimony is false.

Thus to return to Paul’s report of Jesus’ resurrection in 1 Corinthians: It may be highly unlikely that the original witnesses were wrong, for one reason or another, about whether they saw Jesus; it may be highly unlikely that the testimony of these witnesses may have been distorted before reaching Paul; it may be highly unlikely that Paul incorrectly reported what he heard about the event, and it may be highly unlikely that Paul’s original letter to the Christian community in Corinth has not been accurately preserved in our modern translations of the New Testament. Suppose the apologist can argue that a failure in the transmission of testimony at any of these points might be entirely without precedent in human experience. But the physical resurrection of a human being is also without precedent, so that the very best the apologist can hope for is that both alternatives—that the report is incorrect, or that Jesus returned to life—are equally unlikely, which seems only to call for a suspension of judgment. Apologetic appeals frequently focus on the strength of testimony such as Paul’s, and often appear to make a good case for its reliability. Nevertheless such an appeal will only persuade those who are already inclined to believe in the miracle—perhaps because they are already sympathetic to a supernaturalistic worldview—and who therefore tend to downplay the unlikelihood of a dead man returning to life.

Having said all this, it may strike us as odd that Hume seems not to want to rule out the possibility, in principle, that very strong testimony might establish the occurrence of an unprecedented event. He tells us (Enquiries p. 127) that if the sun had gone dark for eight days beginning on January 1, 1600, and that testimony to this fact continued to be received from all over the world and without any variation, we should believe it—and then look for the cause. Thus even if we were convinced that such an event really did take place—and the evidence in this case would be considerably stronger than the evidence for any of the miracles of the Bible—we should suppose that the event in question really had a natural cause after all. In this case the event would not be a violation of natural law, and thus according to Hume’s definition would not be a miracle.

Despite this possibility, Hume wants to say that the quality of miracle reports is never high enough to clear this hurdle, at least when they are given in the interest of establishing a religion, as they typically are. People in such circumstances are likely to be operating under any number of passional influences, such as enthusiasm, wishful thinking, or a sense of mission driven by good intentions; these influences may be expected to undermine their critical faculties. Given the importance to religion of a sense of mystery and wonder, that very quality which would otherwise tend to make a report incredible—that it is the report of something entirely novel—becomes one that recommends it to us. Thus in a religious context we may believe the report not so much in spite of its absurdity as because of it.

5. Problems with Hume’s Argument

There is something clearly right about Hume’s argument. The principle he cites surely resembles the one that we properly use when we discredit reports in tabloid newspapers about alien visitors to the White House or tiny mermaids being found in sardine cans. Nevertheless the argument has prompted a great many criticisms.

Some of this discussion makes use of Bayesian probabilistic analysis; John Earman, for example, argues that when the principles of Hume’s arguments “are made explicit and examined under the lens of Bayesianism, they are found to be either vapid, specious, or at variance with actual scientific practice” (Earman 2000). The Bayesian literature will not be discussed here, though Earman’s discussion of the power of multiple witnessing deserves mention. Earman argues that even if the prior probability of a miracle occurring is very low, if there are enough independent witnesses, and each is sufficiently reliable, its occurrence may be established as probable. Thus if Hume’s concern is to show that we cannot in principle ever have good reason to believe testimony to a miracle, he would appear to be wrong about this (Earman 2000: See particularly Ch. 18 and following). Of course the number of witnesses required might be very large, and it may be that none of the miracles reported in any scripture will qualify. It is true that some of the miracles of the Bible are reported to have occurred in the presence of a good number of witnesses; the miracle of the loaves and fishes is a good example, which according to Mark (Mark 6:30-44) was witnessed by 5,000 people. But we have already noticed that the testimony of one person, or even of four, that some event was witnessed by a multitude is not nearly the same as having the testimony of the multitude itself.

Another objection against Hume’s argument is that it makes use of a method that is unreliable; that is, it may have us reject reports that are true or accept those that are false. Consider the fact that a particular combination of lottery numbers will generally be chosen against very great odds. If the odds of the particular combination chosen in the California Lottery last week were 40 million to 1, the probability of that combination being chosen is very low. Assuming that the likelihood of any given event being misreported in the Los Angeles Times is greater than that, we would not be able to trust the Times to determine which ticket is the winner.

The unreliability objection, made out in this particular way, seems to have a fairly easy response. There is no skeptical challenge to our being justified in believing the report of a lottery drawing; that is, reports of lottery drawings are reports of ordinary events, like reports of rainstorms and presidential press conferences. They do not require particularly strong testimony to be credible, and in fact we may be justified in believing the report of a lottery drawing even if it came from an otherwise unreliable source, such as a tabloid newspaper. This is surely because we know in advance that when the lottery is drawn, whatever particular combination of numbers may be chosen will be chosen against very great odds, so that we are guaranteed to get one highly improbable combination or another. Despite the fact that the odds against any particular combination are very great, all of the other particular outcomes are equally unlikely, so we have no prejudice against any particular combination.  We know that people are going to win the lottery from time to time; we have no comparable assurance that anyone will ever be raised from the dead.

Nevertheless if we are to be able to make progress in science, we must be prepared to revise our understanding of natural law, and there ought to be circumstances in which testimony to an unprecedented event would be credible. For example, human beings collectively have seen countless squid, few of which have ever exceeded a length of two feet. For this reason reports of giant squid have, in the past, been sometimes dismissed as fanciful; the method employed by Hume in his Balance of Probabilities Argument would seem to rule out the possibility of our coming to the conclusion, on the basis of testimony, that such creatures exist—yet they have been found in the deep water near Antarctica. Similarly, someone living beyond the reach of modern technology might well reject reports of electric lighting and airplanes. Surely we should be skeptical when encountering a report of something so novel. But science depends for its progress on an ability to revise even its most confident assertions about the natural world.

Discussion of this particular problem in Hume tends to revolve around his example of the Indian and the ice. Someone from a very hot climate such as that of India, living during Hume’s time, might refuse to believe that water was capable of taking solid form as ice or frost, since he has an exceptionless experience against this. Yet in this case he would come to the wrong conclusion. Hume argues that such a person would reason correctly, and that very strong testimony would properly be required to persuade him otherwise. Yet Hume refers to this not as a miracle but as a marvel; the difference would appear to lie in the fact that while water turning to ice does not conform to the experience of the Indian, since he has experienced no precedent for this, it is also notcontrary to his experience, because he has never had a chance to see what will happen to water when the temperature is sufficiently low (Enquiries, p. 113). By the same token, we ought to be cautious when it comes to deciding how large squid may grow in the Antarctic deeps, when our only experience of them has been in warm and relatively shallow water. The circumstances of an Antarctic habitat are not analogous to those in which we normally observe squid.

On the other hand, when someone reports to us that they have witnessed a miracle, such as a human being walking on water, our experience of ordinary water is analogous to this case, and therefore counts against the likelihood that the report is true. And of course our usual experience must be analogous to this case, for if the water that someone walks upon is somehow unlike ordinary water, or there is something else in the physical circumstances that can account for how it was possible in this one instance for someone to walk on water when this is impossible in the ordinary case, then it is not a violation of natural law after all, and therefore, by Hume’s definition, not a miracle. Jesus’ walking on water will only qualify as a miracle on the assumption that this case is analogous in all relevant respects to those cases in which dense objects have sunk.

The distinction between a miracle and a marvel is an important one for Hume; as he constructs an epistemology that he hopes will rule out belief in miracles in principle, he must be careful that it does not also hinder progress in science. Whether Hume is successful in making this distinction is a matter of some controversy.

a. Does Hume’s Argument Beg the Question?

Many commentators have suggested that Hume’s argument begs the question against miracles. (See for example Lewis 1947:103, Houston 1994:133) Suppose I am considering whether it is possible for a human being to walk on water. I consider my past experience with dense objects, such as human bodies, and their behavior in water; I may even conduct a series of experiments to see what will happen when a human body is placed without support on the surface of a body of water, and I always observe these bodies to sink. I now consider what is likely to occur, or likely to have occurred, in some unknown case. Perhaps I am wondering what will happen the next time I step out into the waters of Silver Lake. Obviously I will expect, without seriously considering the matter, that I will sink rather than walk on its surface. My past experience with water gives me very good reason to think that this is what will happen. But of course in this case, I am not asking whether nature will be following its usual course. Indeed, I am assuming that it will be, since otherwise I would not refer to my past experience to judge what was likely in this particular case; my past experience of what happens with dense bodies in water is relevant only in those cases in which the uniformity of nature is not in question. But this means that to assume that our past experience is relevant in deciding what has happened in an unknown case, as Hume would have us do, is to assume that nature was following its usual course—it is to assume that there has been no break in the uniformity of nature. It is, in short, to assume that no miracle has occurred. In order to take seriously the possibility that a miracle has occurred, we must take seriously the possibility that there has been a breach in the uniformity of nature, which means that we cannot assume, without begging the question, that our ordinary observations are relevant.

It would be a mistake, however, to suppose that this criticism represents a victory for apologetic. While the apologist may wish to proceed by asking the skeptic to abandon his assumption that ordinary experience is relevant to assessing the truth of miracle reports, this seems to beg the question in the opposite direction. Ordinary experience will only fail to be relevant in those cases in which there was in fact a break in the uniformity of nature, i.e. in those cases in which a miracle has occurred, and this is precisely what the skeptic requires to be shown. It is tempting to suppose that there is a middle ground; perhaps the skeptic need only admit that it is possible that ordinary experience is not relevant in this case. However, it is difficult to determine just what sort of possibility this would be. The mere logical possibility that an exceptional event may have occurred is not something that the skeptic has ever questioned; when I infer that I will sink in the waters of Silver Lake, I do so in full recognition of the fact that it is logically possible that I will not.

If the apologist is asking for any greater concession than this, the skeptic may be forgiven for demanding that he be given some justification for granting it. He may be forgiven, too, for demanding that he be persuaded of the occurrence of a miracle on his own terms—i.e. on purely naturalistic grounds, without requiring him to adopt any of the assumptions of supernaturalism. Of course the most natural place to look for evidence that there may occasionally be breaks in the natural order would be to testimony, but for reasons that are now obvious, this will not do.

It would appear that the question of whether miracle reports are credible turns on a larger question, namely, whether we ought to hold the supernaturalistic worldview, or the naturalistic one. One thing seems certain, however, and that is that the apologist cannot depend on miracle reports to establish the supernaturalistic worldview if the credibility of such reports depends on our presumption that the supernaturalistic worldview is correct.

6. Conceptual Difficulties I: The Logical Impossibility of a Violation

Recent criticisms of belief in miracles have focused on the concept of a miracle. In particular, it has been held that the notion of a violation of natural law is self-contradictory. No one, of course, thinks that the report of an event that might be taken as a miracle—such as a resurrection or a walking on water—is logically self-contradictory. Nevertheless some philosophers have argued that it is paradoxical to suggest both that such an event has occurred, and that it is a violation of natural law. This argument dates back at least as far as T.H. Huxley, who tells us that the definition of a miracle as contravening the order of nature is self-contradictory, because all we know of the order of nature is derived from our observation of the course of events of which the so-called miracle is a part (1984:157). Should an apparent miracle take place, such as a suspension in the air of a piece of lead, scientific methodology forbids us from supposing that any law of nature has been violated; on the contrary, Huxley tells us (in a thoroughly Humean vein) that “the scientist would simply set to work to investigate the conditions under which so highly unexpected an occurrence took place; and modify his, hitherto, unduly narrow conception of the laws of nature” (1894:156). More recently this view has been defended by Antony Flew (1966, 1967, 1997) and Alastair McKinnon (1967). McKinnon has argued that in formulating the laws of nature, the scientist is merely trying to codify what actually happens; thus to claim that some event is a miracle, where this is taken to imply that it is a violation of natural law, is to claim at once that it actually occurred, but also, paradoxically, that it is contrary to the actual course of events.

Let us say that a statement of natural law is a generalization of the form “All As are Bs;” for example, all objects made of lead (A) are objects that will fall when we let go of them (B). A violation would be represented by the occurrence of an A that is not a B, or in this case, an object made of lead that does not fall when we let go of it. Thus to assert that a violation of natural law has occurred is to say at once that all As are Bs, but to say at the same time that there exists some A that is not a B; it is to say, paradoxically, that all objects made of lead will fall when left unsupported, but that this object made of lead did not fall when left unsupported. Clearly we cannot have it both ways; should we encounter a piece of lead that does not fall, we will be forced to admit that it is not true that all objects made of lead will fall. On McKinnon’s view, a counterinstance to some statement of natural law negates that statement; it shows that our understanding of natural law is incorrect and must be modified—which implies that no violation has occurred after all.

Of course this does not mean that no one has ever parted the Red Sea, walked on water, or been raised from the dead; it only means that such events, if they occurred, cannot be violations of natural law. Thus arguably, this criticism does not undermine the Christian belief that these events really did occur (Mavrodes 1985:337). But if Antony Flew is correct (1967:148), for the apologist to point to any of these events as providing evidence for the existence of a transcendent God or the truth of a particular religious doctrine, we must not only have good reason to believe that they occurred, but also that they represent an overriding of natural law, an overriding that originates from outside of nature. To have any apologetic value, then, a miracle must be a violation of natural law, which means that we must (per impossibile) have both the law and the exception.

a. Violations as Nonrepeatable Counterinstances to Natural Law

The conception of a violation may, however, be defended as logically coherent. Suppose we take it to be a law of nature that a human being cannot walk on water; subsequently, however, we become convinced that on one particular occasion (O)—say for example, April 18th, 1910—someone was actually able to do this. Yet suppose that after the occurrence of O water goes back to behaving exactly as it normally does. In such a case our formulation of natural law would continue to have its usual predictive value, and surely we would neither abandon it nor revise it. The only revision possible in this case would be to say “Human beings cannot walk on water, except on occasion O.” Yet the amendment in this case is entirely ad hoc; in its reference to a particular event, the revision fails to take the generalized form that statements of natural law normally possess, and it adds no explanatory power to the original formulation of the law. It gives us no better explanation of what has happened in the past, it does nothing to account for the exceptional event O, and it fares no better than the original formulation when it comes to predicting what will happen in the future. In this case O is what might be called a nonrepeatable counterinstance to natural law. Faced with such an event we would retain our old formulation of the law, which is to say that the exceptional event O does not negate that formulation. This means that there is no contradiction implied by affirming the law together with its exception.

Things would be different if we can identify some feature (F) of the circumstances in which O occurred which will explain why O occurred in this one case when normally it would not. F might be some force operating to counteract the usual tendency of a dense object, such as a human body, to sink in water. In this case, on discovery of F we are in a position to reformulate the law in a fruitful way, saying that human beings cannot walk on water except when F is present. Since the exception in this case now has a generalized form (i.e. it expresses the proposition that human beings can walk on water whenever F is present), our reformulation has the kind of generality that a statement of natural law ought to have. It explains the past interaction of dense bodies with water as well as the original formulation did, and it explains why someone was able to walk on water on occasion O. Finally, it will serve to predict what will happen in the future, both when F is absent and when it is present.

We may now, following Ninian Smart (1964:37) and Richard Swinburne (1970:26), understand a violation as a nonrepeatable counterinstance to natural law. We encounter a nonrepeatable counterinstance when someone walks on water, as in case O, and having identified all of the causally relevant factors at work in O, and reproducing these, no one is able to walk on water. Since a statement of natural law is falsified only by the occurrence of a repeatable counterinstance, it is paradoxical to assert a particular statement of law and at the same time insist that a repeatable counterinstance to it has occurred. However there is no paradox in asserting the existence of the law together with the occurrence of a counterinstance that is not repeatable.

b. Miracles as Outside the Scope of Natural Laws

The force of this line of reasoning is to deny that natural laws must describe the actual course of events. Natural laws do not describe absolutely the limits of what can and cannot happen in nature. They only describe nature to the extent that it operates according to laws. To put the matter differently, we might say that natural laws only describe what can happen as a result of natural causes; they do not tell us what can happen when a supernatural cause is present. As Michael Levine (1989:67) has put the point:

Suppose the laws of nature are regarded as nonuniversal or incomplete in the sense that while they cover natural events, they do not cover, and are not intended to cover, non-natural events such as supernaturally caused events if there are or could be any. A physically impossible occurrence would not violate a law of nature because it would not be covered by (i.e. would not fall within the scope of) such a law.

On this understanding, a physically impossible event would be one that could not occur given only physical, or natural, causes. But what is physically impossible is not absolutely impossible, since such an event might occur as the result of a supernatural cause. One way to make this out is to say that all laws must ultimately be understood as disjunctions, of the form “All As are Bs unless some supernatural cause is operating.” (Let us refer to this as a supernaturalistic formulation of law, where of course it is causal supernaturalism that is at work here, as opposed to a naturalistic formulation, which simply asserts that all As are Bs, without taking account the possibility of any supernatural cause.) If this is correct, then it turns out that strictly speaking, a miracle is not a violation of natural law after all, since it is something that occurs by means of a supernatural intervention. Furthermore, since statements of natural law are only intended to describe what happens in the absence of supernatural intrusions, the occurrence of a miracle does not negate any formulation of natural law.

The supernaturalistic conception of natural law appears to offer a response to Hume’s Balance of Probabilities argument; the evidence for natural laws, gathered when supernatural causes are absent, does not weigh against the possibility that a miracle should occur, since a miracle is the result of a supernatural intervention into the natural order. Thus there is a failure of analogy between those cases that form the basis for our statements of natural law, and the circumstances of a miracle. Probabilistic considerations, based on our ordinary experience, are only useful in determining what will happen in the ordinary case, when there are no supernatural causes at work.

7. Conceptual Difficulties II: Identifying Miracles

We have seen two ways in which the concept of a miracle, described as an event that nature cannot produce on its own, may be defended as coherent. We may say that a miracle is a violation of natural law and appeal to the conception of a violation as a nonrepeatable counterinstance, or we may deny that miracles are violations of natural law since, having supernatural causes, they fall outside the scope of these laws. Nevertheless, conceptual difficulties remain. Antony Flew (1966, 1967, 1997) has argued that if a miracle is to serve any apologetic purpose, as evidence for the truth of some revelation, then it must be possible to identify it as a miracle without appealing to criteria given by that revelation; in particular, there must be natural, or observable, criteria by which an event can be determined to be one which nature cannot produce on its own. Flew refers to this as the Problem of Identifying Miracles.

Let us see how this problem arises in connection with these two conceptions of the miraculous. Are there natural criteria by which we can distinguish a repeatable from a nonrepeatable counterinstance to some natural law? Suppose some formulation of natural law (All As are Bs) and some event that is a counterinstance to that formulation (an A that is not a B). The counterinstance will be repeatable just in case there is some natural force F present in the circumstances that is causally responsible for the counterinstance, such that every time F is present, a similar counterinstance will occur. But suppose we do our best to reproduce the circumstances of the event and are unable to do so. We cannot assume that the event is nonrepeatable, for we have no way to eliminate the possibility that we have failed to identify all of the natural forces that were operating to produce the original counterinstance. The exceptional event may have been produced by a natural force that is unknown to us. No observable distinction can be made between a case in which an exception is repeatable, having been produced by some as-yet undiscovered natural force, and one that is not. Worse yet, the naturalist will argue that the very occurrence of the exception is evidence that there is in fact some previously unknown natural force at work; where there is a difference in effects, there must be a difference in causes—which for the naturalist means, of course, natural causes.

Nor does the difficulty go away if we adopt the supernaturalistic view of natural law. On this view, natural laws only describe what happens when supernatural forces are absent; a genuine miracle does not violate natural law because it is the effect of a supernatural cause. Suppose an extraordinary event occurs, which the apologist would like to attribute to a supernatural cause. The following two states of affairs appear to be empirically indistinguishable:

1. The event is the result of a natural cause that we are as yet unable to identify.

2. The event is the result of a supernatural cause.

This, of course, is due to the fact that we do not observe the cause of the event in either of these cases—in the first, it is because the cause is unknown to us, and in the second, because supernatural causes are unobservable ex hypothesi. Thus the issue here is whether we should suppose that our failure to observe any cause for the event is due to our (perhaps temporary) inability to fully identify all of the natural forces that were operating to produce it, or whether it is because the cause, being supernatural, is in principle unobservable. If Flew is right, then in order to identify the event as a miracle, we must find some way to rule out the possibility of ever finding a natural cause for it; furthermore, if the identification of this event as a miracle is to serve any apologetic purpose, we must find some empirical grounds for doing this.

To complicate matters even further, there is yet a third possibility, which is that:

3. The event has no cause at all.

That is, it is possible that the event is simply uncaused or spontaneous. It is clear that there can be no observable difference between an event that has a supernatural cause, since such a cause is in principle unobservable, and one that fails to have a cause. The challenge for an account of miracles as supernaturally caused is to show what the difference is between conceiving an event as having a supernatural cause, and conceiving of it as simply lacking any cause at all.

The implications of this are quite significant: Even if the naturalist were forced to admit that an event had no natural cause, and that nature is, therefore, not fully lawlike, this does not commit him to supernaturalism. It is possible that nature undergoes spontaneous lapses in its uniformity. Such events would be nonrepeatable counterinstances to natural law, but they would not be miracles. They would fall within the unaided potentialities of nature; the naturalist need not admit the necessity of supernatural intervention to produce such events, because their occurrence requires no appeal to any transcendent reality. Indeed, should we become persuaded that an event has occurred that has no natural cause, the naturalist may argue that simplicity dictates that we forgo any appeal to the supernatural, since this would involve the introduction of an additional entity (God) without any corresponding benefit in explanatory power.

8. Supernatural Causes and Supernatural Explanation

The apologist, however, will insist that this is precisely the point. Describing an extraordinary event as the effect of a supernatural cause, and attributing it to divine intervention, is justified by the fact that it offers us a chance to explain it where no natural explanation is available. Assuming (as the naturalist typically does) that nature operates according to physical laws, the occurrence of an apparent exception points to some difference in the circumstances. If no difference in the physical circumstances can be found, then the only explanation available is that there is some supernatural force at work. It is unreasonable to reject such a supernatural explanation in the purely speculative hope that one day a natural explanation may become available.

The notion of a supernatural explanation deserves careful attention. The naturalist will surely argue that the conception of a supernatural explanation—together with its cognate, the notion of a supernatural cause—is confused. This position is motivated by the conviction that the notions of an explanation and of a cause are fundamentally empirical conceptions.

First, as regards the conception of a cause: Paradigmatically, causation is a relation between two entities, a cause (or some set of causal circumstances) and an effect. Now there are many cases in which we witness the effect of a cause that is not seen; I might for example hear the sound of a gunshot, and not see the gun that produced it. Furthermore I will be able to infer that there is a gun somewhere nearby that produced that sound. This is an inference from effect to cause, and is similar to what the apologist would like to do with a miracle, inferring the existence of God (as cause) from the occurrence of the miracle (as effect). But what makes my inference possible in this case is, as Hume would point out, the fact that I have observed a regular conjunction of similar causes with similar effects. This is precisely what is lacking when it comes to supernatural causes. I cannot ever experience the conjunction of a supernatural cause with its effect, since supernatural causes are (by hypothesis) unobservable—nor can I make an inference from any phenomenon in nature to its supernatural cause without such an experience. Indeed given the very uniqueness of God’s miraculous interventions into nature, it is difficult to see how the notion of divine causation could draw on any kind of regularity at all, as empirical causes do.

It is true that science often appeals to invisible entities such as electrons, magnetic fields, and black holes; perhaps the apologist conceives her own appeal as having a similar character (Geivett 1997:183). These things, one may argue, are known only through their observable effects. But the causal properties of such natural entities as electrons and magnetic fields are analogous to those of entities that are observable; this is what entitles us to refer to them as natural entities. Furthermore, these properties may be described in terms of observable regularities, which means that entities like electrons and magnetic fields may play a role in theories that have predictive power. Thus for example, an appeal to electrons can help us predict what will happen when we turn on a light switch. God is not a theoretical entity of this kind. Far from being able to play a role in any empirical regularities, God’s miraculous interventions into nature, as these are conceived by the supernaturalist, are remarkable for their uniqueness.

Another reason for doubting that God can possess causal powers analogous to those enjoyed by natural objects arises from the fact that God is typically conceived as lacking any location in space—and on the view of some philosophers, as being outside of time as well. Causal relationships among natural entities play out against a spatio-temporal background. Indeed it would seem that to speak of God as the cause of events in nature encounters something similar to the Problem of Mind-Body Interaction. (This should not be surprising given the usual conception of God as a nonmaterial entity, i.e. as mind or spirit.) All of the cases of causal interaction of which we are aware occur between physical entities that are fundamentally similar to one another in terms of possessing physical properties such as mass, electrical charge, location in space etc. Thus we know for example how one billiard ball may move another by virtue of the transfer of momentum. But God possesses none of these qualities, and cannot therefore interact with physical objects in any way that we can understand. God cannot, for example, transfer momentum to a physical object if God does not possess mass.

It may be argued that the conception of an explanation is inextricably intertwined with that of causation, so that if the conception of a supernatural cause is an empty one, the notion of a supernatural explanation can hardly be expected to get off the ground. The apologist may respond by distinguishing the sort of explanation she intends to give, when she attributes a miracle to divine agency, from the sort of explanation that is common to the natural sciences. In particular, she might characterize them as personal explanations, which work to explain a phenomenon by reference to the intentions of an agent—in this case God. (See for example Swinburne 1979: Ch. 2) Now, it is true that personal explanations do not have quite the same empirical basis as do scientific ones; nevertheless, like scientific explanations, they do typically have empirical consequences. For example, if I explain Bertrand’s running a red light by saying that he wanted to be on time to his meeting, I have given a personal explanation for Bertrand’s behavior, and it is one that is testable. It will be supported by any observations that tend to confirm the hypothesis that Bertrand is due for a meeting and that being on time is something that he desires, and it will be undermined by any that are contrary to it, such as discovering that Bertrand does not believe that any meeting is imminent. Furthermore this explanation also serves as a basis for rough predictions about other actions that Bertrand might be expected to perform, e.g. he will likely take other steps (possibly involving additional traffic violations) in order to make it to his meeting on time.

The most obvious way in which appeals to divine agency fail to be analogous to the usual sort of personal explanation is in their failure to yield even the vaguest of predictions. (See Nowell-Smith 1955) Suppose, for example, that we attribute a walking on water to divine intervention; from this description, nothing follows about what we can expect to happen in the future. Unless we can introduce additional information provided by revelation, we have no grounds for inferring that God will bring it about that additional miracles will occur; he may, or he may not. Indeed, as far as this kind of predictive expansion is concerned, we seem no better off saying that some event came about because God willed it to occur than we would be if we said of it simply that it had no cause, or that it occurred spontaneously. (Indeed, often when someone says “It was God’s will,” they are calling attention to the inscrutability of events.) In light of this fact, there is no reason why the naturalist should find such a supernatural explanation compelling; on the contrary, faced with a putative miracle, if his concern was to explain the event, he would be justified in following Hume’s advice and continuing to hold out for a natural cause and a natural explanation—one that possesses predictive power—or in the worst case, to simply shrug off the incident as inexplicable, while denying that this inexplicability warrants any appeal to the divine.

An objection here may be that all of this makes use of an unnecessarily narrow conception of causation—one which arbitrarily seeks to restrict their use to the natural sciences. Undoubtedly the word “cause” is used in a very diverse number of ways, and it is surely wrong to say that no sense can ever be attached to a statement of the form “God caused x to occur.” The same may be said regarding the notion of an explanation. But it is the apologist who tries to understand supernatural causes as analogous to the sort of causes that are of interest to natural science. If supernatural causes are not sufficiently similar to natural ones, they cannot be expected to fill the gap when natural causes are found to be lacking.

The most fundamental challenge to someone who wishes to appeal to the existence of supernatural causes is to make it clear just what the difference is between saying that an event has a supernatural cause, and saying that it has no cause at all. Similarly when it comes to the prospect of giving a supernatural explanation: Supposing that someone walks on water and we are unable to find any natural explanation for this, what warrants our saying that such an event has a supernatural explanation, as opposed to saying that it is inexplicable and being done with it?

9. Coincidence Miracles

Given the difficulties that arise in connection with the suggestion that God causes a miracle to occur, a non-causal account deserves consideration. R.F. Holland (1965) has suggested that a religiously significant coincidence may qualify as a miracle. Suppose a child who is riding a toy motor-car gets stuck on the track at a train crossing. A train is approaching from around a curve, and the engineer who is driving it will not be able to see the child until it is too late to stop. By coincidence, the engineer faints at just the right moment, releasing his hand on the control lever, which causes the train to stop automatically. The child, against all expectations, is saved, and his mother thanks God for his providence; she continues to insist that a miracle has occurred even after hearing the explanation of how the train came to stop when it did. Interestingly, when the mother attributes the stopping of the train to God she is not identifying God as its cause; the cause of the train’s stopping is the engineer’s fainting. Nor is she, in any obvious way, offering an explanation for the event—at least none that is intended to compete with the naturalistic explanation made possible by reference to the engineer’s medical condition. What makes this event a miracle, if it is, is its significance, which is given at least in part by its being an apparent response to a human need.

Like a violation miracle, such a coincidence occurs contrary to our expectations, yet it does this without standing in opposition to our understanding of natural law. To conceive of such an event as a miracle does seem to satisfy the notion of a miracle as an event that elicits wonder, though the object of our wonder seems not so much to be how the train came to stop as the simple fact that it should stop when it did, when we had every reason to think it would not.

A similar account of the miraculous comes from John Hick’s conception of religious faith as a form of “experiencing-as.” Inspired by Wittgenstein‘s discussion of seeing-as in the Philosophical Investigations (194e), Hick has argued that while the theist and the atheist live in the same physical environment, they experience it differently; the theist sees a significance in the events of her life that prompts her to describe her experience as a continuing interaction with God (1973:Ch. 2). A theist, for example, might benefit from an unexpected job opportunity and experience this as an expression of divine providence; the same event might not move an atheist in this way. Regarding miracles in particular, Hick (1973:51) writes:

A miracle, whatever else it may be, is an event through which we become vividly and immediately conscious of God as acting towards us. A startling happening, even if it should involve a suspension of natural law, does not constitute for us a miracle in the religious sense of the word if it fails to make us intensely aware of God’s presence. In order to be miraculous, an event must be experienced as religiously significant.

Holland gives no indication that he wants to describe the miracle of the train in terms of experiencing-as. Nevertheless it seems reasonable to say, with Hick, that in Holland’s example, while the child’s mother has seen the same thing that the skeptic has—the stopping of the train—she understands it differently, experiencing it as a miracle, and as an expression of divine providence.

But now a new problem emerges: If the question of whether an event is a miracle lies in its significance, and if its significance is a matter of how we understand it, then it is hard to see how the determination that some event is a miracle can avoid being an entirely subjective matter. In this case, whether or not a miracle has occurred depends on how the witnesses see it, and so (arguably) is more a fact about the witnesses, and their response to the event, than it is to the event itself. (See Smart 1964:35) But we do not typically analyze human agency in this way; whether or not Caesar crossed the Rubicon is not a matter of how anyone experiences things. The question of whether Caesar crossed the Rubicon is an objective one. Surely the theist wishes to say that the question of whether God has acted in the world, in the occurrence of a miracle, is objective as well. And surely this fact accounts for the attractiveness of a causal account of miracles; any dispute over the cause of a putative miracle is a dispute over the facts, not a dispute about how people view the facts.

10. Miracle as Basic Action

This is a serious criticism, but it overlooks something very important about the character of actions generally. To ask whether a human being has acted is surely to ask an objective question, but it is not always to ask a question about causes. Arthur Danto (1965) has argued for a distinction between two types of action: Those that are mediated, and those that are basic. (See also Davidson 1982, who refers to basic actions as primitive.)  I act in a mediated way when I perform action x by doing y; for example, if I turn on the light in my study by flicking a switch, my turning on the light is a mediated action. My flicking the switch is also a mediated action if I flick the switch by moving my fingers.  Notice that, when we say that I turned on the light in a mediated sort of way, this may carry causal implications: In this case, the light’s coming on was caused by the switch’s being flicked, and the switch’s being flicked was caused by my fingers’ moving.  But not all of our actions are like this. When I move my fingers in order to flip the switch, I do not bring about their movement by doing anything else; I just move them. Thus to say I have acted in moving my fingers does not imply that I caused anything to happen. Yet clearly it is, in some sense of “fact,” a fact that I moved my fingers.

It is possible, of course, that my fingers’ moving has a cause, such as the firing of various neurons. But my neural firings are not actions of mine; they are not things that I do. It is not as though I set about to fire my neurons as part of a procedure aimed ultimately at bringing it about that my muscles contract and my fingers move. And even if I did, there would have to be something that I did immediately in order to set the chain of causes going, or there would be an infinite series of actions I would have to perform in order to turn on the light—I could never so much as start to act . Thus the possibility of being able to describe my fingers’ moving in terms of physical causes, and of thereby being able to give a natural explanation for this in terms of neural firings and the like, does not rule out the possibility of saying that in moving my fingers, I have acted.

Some philosophers believe that the truth of a libertarian account of free will implies that the free actions of human beings have no natural cause. This parallels the way that the traditional view of miracles has understood the manner of God’s action in a miracle. (J.P. Moreland has discussed the analogy between free human actions and miracles in this regard; see Moreland 1997.) Such a libertarian view of human action may be correct. It is important to recognize, however, that we do not have to settle the matter; we do not have to show that someone’s moving of their fingers has no natural cause in order to attribute this movement to their agency. Thus analogously, a believer in miracles may insist that there is no natural explanation for various miracles such as the creation of the universe, Moses’ parting of the Red Sea, or Jesus’ resurrection. But if miracles are basic actions on the part of God, then our attribution of divine agency to such events does not require us to show that these things cannot be explained by reference to natural causes. Whatever we must do to identify an event as a miracle, if a miracle is conceived as a basic action on the part of God, it cannot involve a requirement to show that it has no natural cause.

To ascribe a basic action to its agent is not to make any claim about its cause; thus if miracles are properly conceived as basic actions on the part of God, it is not the case that “any assertion that a miracle has occurred is implicitly a causal assertion” (Levine 1994:39), though this view is widely held. On the contrary, the ascription of a miracle to God will be logically independent of any causal analysis. (For a detailed discussion of this point see Corner 2007, and particularly Ch. 4.)

11. Wittgenstein: Miracle as Gesture

This leaves open the question of how we are to identify an event as a miracle, if this does not involve a causal analysis.  One approach is to think of a miracle as a gesture on the part of God. In Culture and Value (1980:45e), Ludwig Wittgenstein writes:

A miracle is, as it were, a gesture that God makes. As a man sits quietly and then makes an impressive gesture, God lets the world run on smoothly and then accompanies the words of a saint by a symbolic occurrence, a gesture of nature. It would be an instance if, when a saint has spoken, the trees around him bowed, as if in reverence.

It is interesting that Wittgenstein should speak of a gesture as a symbolic occurrence. A human bodily movement becomes a gesture when it takes on a particular kind of significance. The significance of a bow, for example, lies in the fact that it is an expression of reverence or respect. Being able to identify a bending at the waist as a bow requires us to be familiar with the culture in which this particular bodily movement has the significance that it does. Nevertheless, the question of whether someone has bowed is an objective one—it is, we might say, a question about the facts. Thus the analogy of a miracle to a gesture may give us a way to view miracles at once as signs, allowing us to say that the character of a miracle lies, at least in part, in its significance within what Wittgenstein would call a “form of life,” and at the same time insist that the question of its significance is an objective matter.

If a miracle is like a gesture in the way Wittgenstein thinks it is, then supposing that a miraculous event should occur, part of what makes it possible to identify that event as a miracle is an appreciation of its significance. But a miracle does not take on its significance in a vacuum; the significance of a miracle, like the significance of a gesture, is dependent on a certain sort of context. This context is established, at least to some degree, by one’s view of the world; whether one is able to identify an event as a miracle will depend on one’s ability to integrate it with a worldview in which the possibility of God’s acting in nature is already acknowledged. Such a limitation poses no problem for theology generally, which might legitimately regard such a view of things as its starting point. It will, however, be fatal to any apologetic appeal that seeks to establish the credentials of theistic religion by pointing to the occurrence of a putative miracle and attempting to establish, on grounds that are consistent with naturalism, that this event gives compelling evidence for the existence of God.

Peter Winch has recently taken up Wittgenstein’s comparison of a miracle to a gesture:

A certain disposition, or movement, of a human body can be called a ‘gesture’ only within a context where it is possible for it to be recognised and/or reacted to as a gesture… Such a possibility depends, at least in large part, on the reigning culture within which the action occurs. (1995:211, emphasis in the original)

Winch observes that our recognition of a gesture is typically immediate rather than inferred. Thus for example, if we are introduced to someone and they bow, we would not normally arrive at the conclusion that they are bowing by means of an inference, after first eliminating the possibility that their movement has a natural explanation; on the contrary, if we are sufficiently familiar with bowing as a cultural institution we will immediately recognize the character of their act. Furthermore, our recognition of the fact that they have bowed will typically be shown in our reaction to their gesture, e.g. in our bowing in return. Analogously, we express our recognition of a miracle not by looking to see if it has any natural cause, but by responding in the manner characteristic of theistic religion; with awe, perhaps, or with gratitude for God’s beneficence. (This is the response of the mother in Holland’s miracle of the train.) But, just as our ability to recognize, and to react appropriately to, a bow depends on our being immersed in a particular culture, so might our ability to recognize a miracle and react to it in the characteristically religious way. If Winch is correct, then the skeptic, who seeks to show that a putative miracle has a natural cause, is proceeding in the wrong direction—but then so is the theist who tries to show that the event cannot be explained scientifically. Such a theist commits the same error as one would who thinks that in order to show that a particular gesture is a bow, we must show that no physiological explanation can be given for it.

The mainstream theistic approach to miracles is, at the moment, one that would prefer to employ a method similar to that used in the natural sciences. Philosophers taking this approach are unlikely to be satisfied with the conception of a miracle as a gesture. But if Winch is right, this is an indication of how deeply embedded science has become in modern western culture, and an indication as well of a drift away from the kind of religious culture in which the conception of a miracle originally found its home.

12. References and Further Reading

• Aquinas, Thomas, Summa Contra Gentiles, III:100-103
• Augustine, The City of God, XXI:8
• Beardsmore, R.W, “Hume and the Miraculous,” Religions and Hume’s Legacy, ed. Phillips, D.Z. and Tessin, Timothy, Claremont Studies in the Philosophy of Religion, New York: St. Martin’s Press
• Corner, David (2007), The Philosophy of Miracles, London: Continuum
• Danto, Arthur C. (1965), “Basic Actions,” American Philosophical Quarterly, 2:141-8
• Davidson, Donald (1982), Essays on Action and Events, New York: Oxford University Press
• Davis, Stephen T (1999), “Beardsmore on Hume on Miracles,” Religions and Hume’s Legacy, ed. Phillips, D.Z. and Tessin, Timothy, Claremont Studies in the Philosophy of Religion, New York: St. Martin’s Press
• Earman, John (2000), Hume’s Abject Failure: The Argument Against Miracles, New York: Oxford University Press
• Hume, David (1975), Enquiries Concerning Human Understanding, Ed. L.A. Selby-Bigge 3rd ed. Oxford: Oxford University Press
• Flew, Anthony (1966), God and Philosophy, New York: Harcourt, Brace and World
• Flew, Anthony (1967), “Miracles,” Encyclopedia of Philosophy. New York: Macmillan and Free Press, 1967, vol. 5, pp. 346-353
• Flew, Anthony (1997), Hume’s Philosophy of Belief, Bristol: Thoemmes Press
• Fogelin, Robert J. (2003), A Defense of Hume on Miracles, Princeton: Princeton University Press
• Geivett, R. Douglas (1997), “The Evidential Value of Miracles,” in Geivett, R. Douglas and Habermas, Gary R. eds (1997), In Defense of Miracles: A Comprehensive Case for God’s Action in History, Downers Grove: Intervarsity Press
• Hick, John (1973), God and the Universe of Faiths, Oxford: Oneworld Publications Ltd.
• Holland, R.F. (1965), “The Miraculous,” American Philosophical Quarterly 2:43-51
• Houston, J. (1994), Reported Miracles, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press
• Huxley, T.H., (1894) Collected Essays, Vol. VI, Hume:, With Helps to the Study of Berkeley, New York: D. Appleton and Company
• Lewis, C.S. (1947), Miracles, New York: Macmillan
• Levine, Michael, P. (1989), Hume and the Problem of Miracles: A Solution, Dordrecht: Kluwer Publishers
• Locke, John (2000), A Discourse of Miracles, in Earman, John, Hume’s Abject Failure: The Argument Against Miracles, New York: Oxford University Press
• Mackie. J.L. (1982), The Miracle of Theism: Arguments for and against the Existence of God New York: Oxford University Press
• Martin, Michael (1992), Atheism: A Philosophical Justification, Philadelphia: Temple University Press
• Mavrodes, George I. (1985), “Miracles and the Laws of Nature,” Faith and Philosophy, Vol. 2 No. 4, October 1985
• McKinnon, Alastair (1967), “Miracle’ and ‘Paradox,” American Philosophical Quarterly, 4:308-314
• Moore, Gareth (1996), Believing in God, Edinburgh: T & T Clark
• Nowell-Smith, Patrick (1955), “Miracles,” in New Essays in Philosophical Theology, ed. Antony Flew and Alastair MacIntyre, New York: Macmillan
• Melden, A.I. (1961), Free Action, London: Routledge & Kegan Paul
• Moreland, J.P (1997), “Science, Miracles, Agency Theory & the God-of-the-Gaps,” in Geivett, R. Douglas and Habermas, Gary R. eds (1997), In Defense of Miracles: A Comprehensive case for God’s Action in History,Downers Grove: Intervarsity Press
• Purtill, Richard (1978), “Thinking about Religion: A Philosophical Introduction to Religion,” Prentice-Hall
• Smart, Ninian (1964), Philosophers and Religious Truth, New York: Macmillan
• Swinburne, Richard (1970), The Concept of Miracle, London: Macmillan
• Swinburne, Richard (1979), The Existence of God, Oxford: Clarendon Press
• Swinburne, Richard ed. (1989), Miracles, from the series Philosophical Topics ed. Paul Edwards, New York: Macmillan
• Winch, Peter (1995), “Asking Too Many Questions,” in Tessin, Timothy and von der Ruhr, Mario eds, Philosophy and the Grammar of Religious Belief, Claremont Studies in the Philosophy of Religion, New York: St. Martin’s Press.
• Wittgenstein, Ludwig (1958), Philosophical Investigations, 3rd edition, tr. G.E.M. Anscombe, Basil Blackwell & Mott, Ltd.
• Wittgenstein, Ludwig (1980), Culture and Value, tr. Peter Winch, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.

Author Information

David Corner
Email: dcorner@csus.edu
California State University Sacramento
U. S. A.

Faith: Historical Perspectives

Traditionally, faith and reason have each been considered to be sources of justification for religious belief. Because both can purportedly serve this same epistemic function, it has been a matter of much interest to philosophers and theologians how the two are related and thus how the rational agent should treat claims derived from either source. Some have held that there can be no conflict between the two—that reason properly employed and faith properly understood will never produce contradictory or competing claims—whereas others have maintained that faith and reason can (or even must) be in genuine contention over certain propositions or methodologies. Those who have taken the latter view disagree as to whether faith or reason ought to prevail when the two are in conflict. Kierkegaard, for instance, prioritizes faith even to the point that it becomes positively irrational, while Locke emphasizes the reasonableness of faith to such an extent that a religious doctrine’s irrationality—conflict with itself or with known facts—is a sign that it is unsound. Other thinkers have theorized that faith and reason each govern their own separate domains, such that cases of apparent conflict are resolved on the side of faith when the claim in question is, say, a religious or theological claim, but resolved on the side of reason when the disputed claim is, for example, empirical or logical. Some relatively recent philosophers, most notably the logical positivists, have denied that there is a domain of thought or human existence rightly governed by faith, asserting instead that all meaningful statements and ideas are accessible to thorough rational examination. This has presented a challenge to religious thinkers to explain how an admittedly nonrational or transrational form of language can hold meaningful cognitive content.

This article traces the historical development of thought on the interrelation of religious faith and reason, beginning with Classical Greek conceptions of mind and religious mythology and continuing through the medieval Christian theologians, the rise of science proper in the early modern period, and the reformulation of the issue as one of ‘science versus religion’ in the twentieth century. (Also, see Faith: Contemporary Issues.)

Table of Contents

1. Introduction
2. The Classical Period
   1. Aristotle and Plato
   2. Stoics and Epicureans
   3. Plotinus
3. The Rise of Christianity
   1. St. Paul
   2. Early Christian Apologists
   3. St. Augustine
   4. Pseudo-Dionysius
4. The Medieval Period
   1. St. Anselm
   2. Peter Lombard
   3. Islamic Philosophers
   4. Jewish Philosophy
   5. St. Thomas Aquinas
   6. The Franciscan Philosophers
5. The Renaissance and Enlightenment Periods
   1. The Galileo Controversy
   2. Erasmus
   3. The Protestant Reformers
   4. Continental Rationalism
   5. Blaise Pascal
   6. Empiricism
   7. German Idealism
6. The Nineteenth Century
   1. Romanticism
   2. Socialism
   3. Existentialism
   4. Catholic Apologists
   5. Pragmatism
7. The Twentieth Century
   1. Logical Positivism and Its Critics
   2. Philosophical Theology
   3. Neo-Existentialism
   4. Neo-Darwinism
   5. Contemporary Reactions Against Naturalism and Neo-Darwinism
   6. Liberation Theology
8. References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

Faith and reason are both sources of authority upon which beliefs can rest. Reason generally is understood as the principles for a methodological inquiry, whether intellectual, moral, aesthetic, or religious. Thus is it not simply the rules of logical inference or the embodied wisdom of a tradition or authority. Some kind of algorithmic demonstrability is ordinarily presupposed. Once demonstrated, a proposition or claim is ordinarily understood to be justified as true or authoritative. Faith, on the other hand, involves a stance toward some claim that is not, at least presently, demonstrable by reason. Thus faith is a kind of attitude of trust or assent. As such, it is ordinarily understood to involve an act of will or a commitment on the part of the believer. Religious faith involves a belief that makes some kind of either an implicit or explicit reference to a transcendent source. The basis for a person’s faith usually is understood to come from the authority of revelation. Revelation is either direct, through some kind of direct infusion, or indirect, usually from the testimony of an other. The religious beliefs that are the objects of faith can thus be divided into those what are in fact strictly demonstrable (scienta) and those that inform a believer’s virtuous practices (sapientia).

Religious faith is of two kinds: evidence-sensitive and evidence-insensitive. The former views faith as closely coordinated with demonstrable truths; the latter more strictly as an act of the will of the religious believer alone. The former includes evidence garnered from the testimony and works of other believers. It is, however, possible to hold a religious belief simply on the basis either of faith alone or of reason alone. Moreover, one can even lack faith in God or deny His existence, but still find solace in the practice of religion.

The basic impetus for the problem of faith and reason comes from the fact that the revelation or set of revelations on which most religions are based is usually described and interpreted in sacred pronouncements, either in an oral tradition or canonical writings, backed by some kind of divine authority. These writings or oral traditions are usually presented in the literary forms of narrative, parable, or discourse. As such, they are in some measure immune from rational critique and evaluation. In fact even the attempt to verify religious beliefs rationally can be seen as a kind of category mistake. Yet most religious traditions allow and even encourage some kind of rational examination of their beliefs.

The key philosophical issue regarding the problem of faith and reason is to work out how the authority of faith and the authority of reason interrelate in the process by which a religious belief is justified or established as true or justified. Four basic models of interaction are possible.

(a) The conflict model. Here the aims, objects, or methods of reason and faith seem to be very much the same. Thus when they seem to be saying different things, there is genuine rivalry. This model is thus assumed both by religious fundamentalists, who resolve the rivalry on the side of faith, and scientific naturalists, who resolve it on the side of reason.

(b) The incompatibilist model. Here the aims, objects, and methods of reason and faith are understood to be distinct. Compartmentalization of each is possible. Reason aims at empirical truth; religion aims at divine truths. Thus no rivalry exists between them. This model subdivides further into three subdivisions. First, one can hold faith is transrational, inasmuch as it is higher than reason. This latter strategy has been employed by some Christian existentialists. Reason can only reconstruct what is already implicit in faith or religious practice. Second, one can hold that religious belief is irrational, thus not subject to rational evaluation at all. This is the position taken ordinarily by those who adopt negative theology, the method that assumes that all speculation about God can only arrive at what God is not. The latter subdivision also includes those theories of belief that claim that religious language is only metaphorical in nature. This and other forms of irrationalism result in what is ordinarily considered fideism: the conviction that faith ought not to be subjected to any rational elucidation or justification.

(c) The weak compatibilist model. Here it is understood that dialogue is possible between reason and faith, though both maintain distinct realms of evaluation and cogency. For example, the substance of faith can be seen to involve miracles; that of reason to involve the scientific method of hypothesis testing. Much of the Reformed model of Christianity adopts this basic model.

(d) The strong compatibilist model. Here it is understood that faith and reason have an organic connection, and perhaps even parity. A typical form of strong compatibilism is termed natural theology. Articles of faith can be demonstrated by reason, either deductively (from widely shared theological premises) or inductively (from common experiences). It can take one of two forms: either it begins with justified scientific claims and supplements them with valid theological claims unavailable to science, or it starts with typical claims within a theological tradition and refines them by using scientific thinking. An example of the former would be the cosmological proof for God’s existence; an example of the latter would be the argument that science would not be possible unless God’s goodness ensured that the world is intelligible. Many, but certainly not all, Roman Catholic philosophers and theologians hold to the possibility of natural theology. Some natural theologians have attempted to unite faith and reason into a comprehensive metaphysical system. The strong compatibilist model, however, must explain why God chose to reveal Himself at all since we have such access to him through reason alone.

The interplay between reason and faith is an important topic in the philosophy of religion. It is closely related to, but distinct from, several other issues in the philosophy of religion: namely, the existence of God, divine attributes, the problem of evil, divine action in the world, religion and ethics, religious experience and religious language, and the problem of religious pluralism. Moreover, an analysis of the interplay between faith and reason also provides resources for philosophical arguments in other areas such as metaphysics, ontology, and epistemology.

While the issues the interplay between faith and reason addresses are endemic to almost any religious faith, this article will focus primarily on the faith claims found in the three great monotheistic world religions: Judaism, Islam, and particularly Christianity.

This rest of the article will trace out the history of the development of thinking about the relationship between faith and reason in Western philosophy from the classical period of the Greeks through the end of the twentieth century.

2. The Classical Period

Greek religions, in contrast to Judaism, speculated primarily not on the human world but on the cosmos as a whole. They were often formulated as literary myths. Nonetheless these forms of religious speculation were generally practical in nature: they aimed to increase personal and social virtue in those who engaged in them. Most of these religions involved civic cultic practices.

Philosophers from the earliest times in Greece tried to distill metaphysical issues out of these mythological claims. Once these principles were located and excised, these philosophers purified them from the esoteric speculation and superstition of their religious origins. They also decried the proclivities to gnosticism and elitism found in the religious culture whence the religious myths developed. None of these philosophers, however, was particularly interested in the issue of willed assent to or faith in these religious beliefs as such.

a. Aristotle and Plato

Both Plato and Aristotle found a principle of intellectual organization in religious thinking that could function metaphysically as a halt to the regress of explanation. In Plato, this is found in the Forms, particularly the Form of the Good. The Form of Good is that by which all things gain their intelligibility. Aristotle rejected the Form of the Good as unable to account for the variety of good things, appealing instead to the unmoved mover as an unchangeable cosmic entity. This primary substance also has intelligence as nous: it is “thought thinking itself.” From this mind emerges exemplars for existent things.

Both thinkers also developed versions of natural theology by showing how religious beliefs emerge from rational reflections on concrete reality as such. An early form of religious apologetics – demonstrating the existence of the gods — can be found in Plato’s Laws. Aristotle’s Physics gave arguments demonstrating the existence of an unmoved mover as a timeless self-thinker from the evidence of motion in the world.

b. Stoics and Epicureans

Both of these schools of thought derived certain theological kinds of thinking from physics and cosmology. The Stoics generally held a cosmological view of an eternal cycle of identical world-revolutions and world-destructions by a universal conflagration. Absolute necessity governs the cyclic process and is identified with divine reason (logos) and providence. This provident and benevolent God is immanent in the physical world. God orders the universe, though without an explicit purpose. Humans are microcosms; their souls are emanations of the fiery soul of the universe.

The Epicureans, on the other hand, were skeptical, materialistic, and anti-dogmatic. It is not clear they were theists at all, though at some points they seem to be. They did speak of the gods as living in a blissful state in intermundial regions, without any interest in the affairs of humans. There is no relation between the evils of human life and a divine guidance of the universe. At death all human perception ceases.

c. Plotinus

Plotinus, in the Enneads, held that all modes of being and value originate in an overflow of procession from a single ineffable power that he identified with the radical simplicity of the One of Parmenides or the Good of Plato’s Republic. Nous, the second hypostasis after the One, resembles Aristotle’s unmoved mover. The orders of the world soul and nature follow after Nous in a linear procession. Humans contain the potentialities of these creative principles, and can choose to make their lives an ascent towards and then a union with the intuitive intelligence. The One is not a being, but infinite being. It is the cause of beings. Thus Christian and Jewish philosophers who held to a creator God could affirm such a conception. Plotinus might have been the first negative theologian, arguing that God, as simple, is know more from what he is not, than from what he is.

3. The Rise of Christianity

Christianity, emerging from Judaism, imposed a set of revealed truths and practices on its adherents. Many of these beliefs and practices differed significantly from what the Greek religions and Judaism had held. For example, Christians held that God created the world ex nihilo, that God is three persons, and that Jesus Christ was the ultimate revelation of God. Nonetheless, from the earliest of times, Christians held to a significant degree of compatibility between faith and reason.

a. St. Paul

The writings attributed to St. Paul in the Christian Scriptures provide diverse interpretations of the relation between faith and reason. First, in the Acts of the Apostles, Paul himself engages in discussion with “certain Epicurean and Stoic philosophers” at the Aeropagus in Athens (Acts 17:18). Here he champions the unity of the Christian God as the creator of all. God is “not far from any one of us.” Much of Paul’s speech, in fact, seems to allude to Stoic beliefs. It reflects a sympathy with pagan customs, handles the subject of idol worship gently, and appeals for a new examination of divinity not from the standpoint of creation, but from practical engagement with the world. However, he claims that this same God will one day come to judge all mankind. But in his famous passage from Romans 1:20, Paul is less obliging to non-Christians. Here he champions a natural theology against those pagans who would claim that, even on Christian grounds, their previous lack of access to the Christian God would absolve them from guilt for their nonbelief. Paul argues that in fact anyone can attain to the truth of God’s existence merely from using his or her reason to reflect on the natural world. Thus this strong compatibilist interpretation entailed a reduced tolerance for atheists and agnostics. Yet in 1 Corinthians 1:23, Paul suggests a kind of incompatibilism, claiming that Christian revelation is folly the Gentiles (meaning Greeks). He points out that the world did not come to know God through wisdom; God chose to reveal Himself fully to those of simple faith.

These diverse Pauline interpretations of the relation between faith and reason were to continue to manifest themselves in various ways through the centuries that followed.

b. Early Christian Apologists

The early apologists were both compatibilists and incompatibilists. Tertullian took up the ideas of Paul in 1 Corinthians, proclaiming that Christianity is not merely incompatible with but offensive to natural reason. Jerusalem has nothing to do with Athens. He boldly claimed credo quia absurdum est (“I believe because it is absurd”). He claims that religious faith is both against and above reason. In his De Praescriptione Haereticorum, he proclaims, “when we believe, we desire to believe nothing further.”

On the other hand, Justin Martyr converted to Christianity, but continued to hold Greek philosophy in high esteem. In his Dialogue with Trypho he finds Christianity “the only sure and profitable philosophy.”

In a similar vein, Clement of Alexandria in his Stromata called the Gospel “the true philosophy.” Philosophy acted as a “schoolmaster” to bring the Greeks to Christ, just as the law brought the Jews. But he maintained that Greek philosophy is unnecessary for a defense of the faith, though it helps to disarm sophistry. He also worked to demonstrate in a rational way what is found in faith. He claimed that “I believe in order that I may know” (credo ut intelligam). This set Christianity on firmer intellectual foundations. Clement also worked to clarify the early creeds of Christianity, using philosophical notions of substance, being, and person, in order to combat heresies.

c. St. Augustine

Augustine emerged in the late fourth century as a rigorous defender of the Christian faith. He responded forcefully to pagans’ allegations that Christian beliefs were not only superstitious but also barbaric. But he was, for the most part, a strong compatibilist. He felt that intellectual inquiry into the faith was to be understood as faith seeking understanding (fides quaerens intellectum). To believe is “to think with assent” (credere est assensione cogitare). It is an act of the intellect determined not by the reason, but by the will. Faith involves a commitment “to believe in a God,” “to believe God,” and “to believe in God.”

In On Christian Doctrine Augustine makes it clear that Christian teachers not only may, but ought, to use pagan thinking when interpreting Scripture. He points out that if a pagan science studies what is eternal and unchanging, it can be used to clarify and illuminate the Christian faith. Thus logic, history, and the natural sciences are extremely helpful in matters of interpreting ambiguous or unknown symbols in the Scriptures. However, Augustine is equally interested to avoid any pagan learning, such as that of crafts and superstition that is not targeted at unchangeable knowledge.

Augustine believed that Platonists were the best of philosophers, since they concentrated not merely on the causes of things and the method of acquiring knowledge, but also on the cause of the organized universe as such. One does not, then, have to be a Christian to have a conception of God. Yet, only a Christian can attain to this kind of knowledge without having to have recourse to philosophy.

Augustine argued further that the final authority for the determination of the use of reason in faith lies not with the individual, but with the Church itself. His battle with the Manichean heresy prompted him to realize that the Church is indeed the final arbiter of what cannot be demonstrated–or can be demonstrated but cannot be understood by all believers. Yet despite this appeal to ecclesiastical authority, he believe that one cannot genuinely understand God until one loves Him.

d. Pseudo-Dionysius

Pseudo Dionysius was heavily influenced by neo-Platonism. In letter IX of his Corpus Dionysiacum, he claimed that our language about God provides no information about God but only a way of protecting God’s otherness. His analysis gave rise to the unique form negative theology. It entailed a severe restriction in our access to and understanding of the nature of God. In his “Mystical Theology” Pseudo-Dionysius describes how the soul’s destiny is to be fully united with the ineffable and absolutely transcendent God.

4. The Medieval Period

Much of the importance of this period stems from its retrieval of Greek thinking, particularly that of Aristotle. At the beginning of the period Arab translators set to work translating and distributing many works of Greek philosophy, making them available to Jewish, Islamic, and Christian philosophers and theologians alike.

For the most part, medieval theologians adopted an epistemological distinction the Greeks had developed: between scienta (episteme), propositions established on the basis of principles, and opinio, propositions established on the basis of appeals to authority. An established claim in theology, confirmed by either scienta or opinio, demanded the believer’s assent. Yet despite this possibility of scientia in matters of faith, medieval philosophers and theologians believed that it could be realized only in a limited sense. They were all too aware of St. Paul’s caveat that faith is a matter of “seeing in a mirror dimly” (1 Cor 1:13).

a. St. Anselm

Like Augustine, Anselm held that one must love God in order to have knowledge of Him. In the Proslogion, he argues that “the smoke of our wrongdoing” will prohibit us from this knowledge. Anselm is most noted, however, for his ontological argument, presented in his Proslogion. He claimed that it is possible for reason to affirm that God exists from inferences made from what the understanding can conceive within its own confines. As such he was a gifted natural theologian. Like Augustine, Anselm held that the natural theologian seeks not to understand in order to believe, but to believe in order to understand. This is the basis for his principle intellectus fidei. Under this conception, reason is not asked to pass judgment on the content of faith, but to find its meaning and to discover explanations that enable others to understand its content. But when reason confronts what is incomprehensible, it remains unshaken since it is guided by faith’s affirmation of the truth of its own incomprehensible claims.

b. Peter Lombard

Lombard was an important precursor to Aquinas. Following Augustine, he argued that pagans can know about much about truths of the one God simply by their possession of reason (e.g. that spirit is better than body, the mutable can exists only from a immutable principle, all beauty points to a beauty beyond compare). But in addition, pagans can affirm basic truths about the Trinity from these same affirmations, inasmuch as all things mirror three attributes associated with the Trinity: unity (the Father), form or beauty (the Son), and a position or order (the Holy Spirit).

c. Islamic Philosophers

Islamic philosophers in the tenth and eleventh centuries were also heavily influenced by the reintroduction of Aristotle into their intellectual culture.

Avicenna (Ibn Sina) held that as long as religion is properly construed it comprises an area of truth no different than that of philosophy. He built this theory of strong compatibilism on the basis of his philosophical study of Aristotle and Plotinus and his theological study of his native Islam. He held that philosophy reveals that Islam is the highest form of life. He defended the Islamic belief in the immortality of individual souls on the grounds that, although as Aristotle taught the agent intellect was one in all persons, the unique potential intellect of each person, illuminated by the agent intellect, survives death.

Averroes (Ibn Rushd), though also a scholar of Aristotle’s works, was less sympathetic to compatibilism than his predecessor Avicenna. But in his Incoherence of Incoherence, he attacked Algazel’s criticisms of rationalism in theology. For example, he developed a form of natural theology in which the task of proving the existence of God is possible. He held, however, that it could be proven only from the physical fact of motion. Nonetheless Averroes did not think that philosophy could prove all Islamic beliefs, such as that of individual immortality. Following Aristotle in De Anima, Averroes argued for a separation between the active and passive intellects, even though they enter into a temporary connection with individual humans. This position entails the conclusion that no individuated intellect survives death. Yet Averroes held firmly to the contrary opinion by faith alone.

d. Jewish Philosophy

Moses Maimonides, a Jewish philosopher, allowed for a significant role of reason in critically interpreting the Scriptures. But he is probably best known for his development of negative theology. Following Avicenna’s affirmation of a real distinction between essence and existence, Maimonides concluded that no positive essential attributes may be predicated of God. God does not possess anything superadded to his essence, and his essence includes all his perfections. The attributes we do have are derived from the Pentateuch and the Prophets. Yet even these positive attributes, such as wisdom and power, would imply defects in God if applied to Him in the same sense they are applied to us. Since God is simple, it is impossible that we should know one part, or predication, of Him and not another. He argues that when one proves the negation of a thing believed to exist in God, one becomes more perfect and closer to knowledge of God. He quotes Psalm 4:4’s approval of an attitude of silence towards God. Those who do otherwise commit profanity and blasphemy. It is not certain, however, whether Maimonides rejected the possibility of positive knowledge of the accidental attributes of God’s action.

e. St. Thomas Aquinas

Unlike Augustine, who made little distinction between explaining the meaning of a theological proposition and giving an argument for it, Aquinas worked out a highly articulated theory of theological reasoning. St. Bonaventure, an immediate precursor to Aquinas, had argued that no one could attain to truth unless he philosophizes in the light of faith. Thomas held that our faith in eternal salvation shows that we have theological truths that exceed human reason. But he also claimed that one could attain truths about religious claims without faith, though such truths are incomplete. In the Summa Contra Gentiles he called this a “a two fold truth” about religious claims, “one to which the inquiry of reason can reach, the other which surpasses the whole ability of the human reason.” No contradiction can stand between these two truths. However, something can be true for faith and false (or inconclusive) in philosophy, though not the other way around. This entails that a non-believer can attain to truth, though not to the higher truths of faith.

A puzzling question naturally arises: why are two truths needed? Isn’t one truth enough? Moreover, if God were indeed the object of rational inquiry in this supernatural way, why would faith be required at all? In De Veritate (14,9) Thomas responds to this question by claiming that one cannot believe by faith and know by rational demonstration the very same truth since this would make one or the other kind of knowledge superfluous.

On the basis of this two-fold theory of truth, Aquinas thus distinguished between revealed (dogmatic) theology and rational (philosophical) theology. The former is a genuine science, even though it is not based on natural experience and reason. Revealed theology is a single speculative science concerned with knowledge of God. Because of its greater certitude and higher dignity of subject matter, it is nobler than any other science. Philosophical theology, though, can make demonstrations using the articles of faith as its principles. Moreover, it can apologetically refute objections raised against the faith even if no articles of faith are presupposed. But unlike revealed theology, it can err.

Aquinas claimed that the act of faith consists essentially in knowledge. Faith is an intellectual act whose object is truth. Thus it has both a subjective and objective aspect. From the side of the subject, it is the mind’s assent to what is not seen: “Faith is the evidence of things that appear not” (Hebrews 11:1). Moreover, this assent, as an act of will, can be meritorious for the believer, even though it also always involves the assistance of God’s grace. Moreover, faith can be a virtue, since it is a good habit, productive of good works. However, when we assent to truth in faith, we do so on the accepted testimony of another. From the side of what is believed, the objective aspect, Aquinas clearly distinguished between “preambles of faith,” which can be established by philosophical principles, and “articles of faith” that rest on divine testimony alone. A proof of God’s existence is an example of a preamble of faith. Faith alone can grasp, on the other hand, the article of faith that the world was created in time (Summa Theologiae I, q. 46, a. 2). Aquinas argued that the world considered in itself offers no grounds for demonstrating that it was once all new. Demonstration is always about definitions, and definitions, as universal, abstract from “the here and now.” A temporal beginning, thus demonstrated, is ruled out tout court. Of course this would extend to any argument about origination of the first of any species in a chain of efficient causes. Here Thomas sounds a lot like Kant will in his antinomies. Yet by faith we believe the world had a beginning. However, one rational consideration that suggests, though not definitively, a beginning to the world is that the passage from one term to another includes only a limited number of intermediate points between them.

Aquinas thus characterizes the articles of faith as first truths that stand in a “mean between science and opinion.” They are like scientific claims since their objects are true; they are like mere opinions in that they have not been verified by natural experience. Though he agrees with Augustine that no created intellect can comprehend God as an object, the intellect can grasp his existence indirectly. The more a cause is grasped, the more of its effects can be seen in it; and since God is the ultimate cause of all other reality, the more perfectly an intellect understands God, the greater will be its knowledge of the things God does or can do. So although we cannot know the divine essence as an object, we can know whether He exists and on the basis of analogical knowledge what must necessarily belong to Him. Aquinas maintains, however, that some objects of faith, such as the Trinity or the Incarnation, lie entirely beyond our capacity to understand them in this life.

Aquinas also elucidates the relationship between faith and reason on the basis of a distinction between higher and lower orders of creation. Aquinas criticizes the form of naturalism that holds that the goodness of any reality “is whatever belongs to it in keeping with its own nature” without need for faith (II-IIae, q.2, a.3). Yet, from reason itself we know that every ordered pattern of nature has two factors that concur in its full development: one on the basis of its own operation; the other, on the basis of the operation of a higher nature. The example is water: in a lower pattern, it naturally flows toward the centre, but in virtue of a higher pattern, such as the pull of the moon, it flows around the center. In the realm of our concrete knowledge of things, a lower pattern grasps only particulars, while a higher pattern grasps universals.

Given this distinction of orders, Thomas shows how the lower can indeed point to the higher. His arguments for God’s existence indicate this possibility. From this conviction he develops a highly nuanced natural theology regarding the proofs of God’s existence. The first of his famous five ways is the argument from motion. Borrowing from Aristotle, Aquinas holds to the claim that, since every physical mover is a moved mover, the experience of any physical motion indicates a first unmoved mover. Otherwise one would have to affirm an infinite chain of movers, which he shows is not rationally possible. Aquinas then proceeds to arguments from the lower orders of efficient causation, contingency, imperfection, and teleology to affirm the existence of a unitary all-powerful being. He concludes that these conclusions compel belief in the Judeo-Christian God.

Conversely, it is also possible to move from the higher to the lower orders. Rational beings can know “the meaning of the good as such” since goodness has an immediate order to the higher pattern of the universal source of being (II-IIae q.2, a.3). The final good considered by the theologian differs from that considered by the philosopher: the former is the bonum ultimum grasped only with the assistance of revelation; the latter is the beatific vision graspable in its possibility by reason. Both forms of the ultimate good have important ramifications, since they ground not only the moral distinction between natural and supernatural virtues, but also the political distinction between ecclesial and secular power.

Aquinas concludes that we come to know completely the truths of faith only through the virtue of wisdom (sapientia). Thomas says that “whatever its source, truth of is of the Holy Spirit” (Summa Theologiae, I-IIae q. 109, a. 1). The Spirit “enables judgment according to divine truth” (II-IIae 45, q. 1, ad 2). Moreover, faith and charity are prerequisites for the achievement of this wisdom.

Thomas’s two-fold theory of truth develops a strong compatibilism between faith and reason. But it can be argued that after his time what was intended as a mutual autonomy soon became an expanding separation.

f. The Franciscan Philosophers

Duns Scotus, like his successor William of Ockham, reacted in a characteristic Franciscan way to Thomas’s Dominican views. While the Dominicans tended to affirm the possibility of rational demonstrability of certain preambles of faith, the Franciscans tended more toward a more restricted theological science, based solely on empirical and logical analysis of beliefs.

Scotus first restricts the scope of Aquinas’s rational theology by refuting its ability to provide arguments that stop infinite regresses. In fact he is wary of the attempts of natural theology to prove anything about higher orders from lower orders. On this basis, he rejects the argument from motion to prove God’s existence. He admits that lower beings move and as such they require a first mover; but he maintains that one cannot prove something definitive about higher beings from even the most noble of lower beings. Instead, Scotus thinks that reason can be employed only to elucidate a concept. In the realm of theology, the key concept to elucidate is that of infinite being. So in his discussion of God’s existence, he takes a metaphysical view of efficiency, arguing that there must be not a first mover, but an actually self-existent being which makes all possibles possible. In moving towards this restricted form of conceptualist analysis, he thus gives renewed emphasis to negative theology.

Ockham then radicalized Scotus’s restrictions of our knowledge of God. He claimed that the Greek metaphysics of the 13^th century, holding to the necessity of causal connections, contaminated the purity of the Christian faith. He argued instead that we cannot know God as a deduction from necessary principles. In fact, he rejected the possibility that any science can verify any necessity, since nothing in the world is necessary: if A and B are distinct, God could cause one to exist without the other. So science can demonstrate only the implications of terms, premises, and definitions. It keeps within the purely conceptual sphere. Like Scotus he argued held that any necessity in an empirical proposition comes from the divine order. He concluded that we know the existence of God, his attributes, the immortality of the soul, and freedom only by faith. His desire to preserve divine freedom and omnipotence thus led in the direction of a voluntaristic form of fideism.

5. The Renaissance and Enlightenment Periods

Ockham’s denial of the necessity in the scope of scientific findings perhaps surprisingly heralded the beginnings of a significant movement towards the autonomy of empirical science. But with this increased autonomy came also a growing incompatibility between the claims of science and those of religious authorities. Thus the tension between faith and reason now became set squarely for the first time in the conflict between science and religion. This influx of scientific thinking undermined the hitherto reign of Scholasticism. By the seventeenth century, what had begun as a criticism of the authority of the Church evolved into a full-blown skepticism regarding the possibility of any rational defense of fundamental Christian beliefs.

The Protestant Reformers shifted their emphasis from the medieval conception of faith as a fides (belief that) to fiducia (faith in). Thus attitude and commitment of the believer took on more importance. The Reformation brought in its wake a remarkable new focus on the importance of the study of Scripture as a warrant for one’s personal beliefs.

The Renaissance also witnessed the development of a renewed emphasis on Greek humanism. In the early part of this period, Nicholas of Cusa and others took a renewed interest in Platonism.

a. The Galileo Controversy

In the seventeenth century, Galileo understood “reason” as scientific inference based and experiment and demonstration. Moreover, experimentation was not a matter simply of observation, it also involved measurement, quantification, and formulization of the properties of the objects observed. Though he was not the first to do attempt this systematization — Archimedes had done the same centuries before – Galileo developed it to such an extent that he overthrew the foundations of Aristotelian physics. He rejected, for example, Aristotle’s claim that every moving had a mover whose force had to be continually applied. In fact it was possible to have more than one force operating on the same body at the same time. Without the principle of a singular moved mover, it was also conceivable that God could have “started” the world, then left it to move on its own.

The finding of his that sparked the great controversy with the Catholic Church was, however, Galileo’s defense of Copernicus’s rejection of the Ptolemaic geocentric universe. Galileo used a telescope he had designed to confirm the hypothesis of the heliocentric system. He also hypothesized that the universe might be indefinitely large. Realizing that such conclusions were at variance with Church teaching, he followed Augustine’s rule than an interpretation of Scripture should be revised when it confronts properly scientific knowledge.

The officials of the Catholic Church – with some exceptions — strongly resisted these conclusions and continued to champion a pre-Copernican conception of the cosmos. The Church formally condemned Galileo’s findings for on several grounds. First, the Church tended to hold to a rather literal interpretation of Scripture, particularly of the account of creation in the book of Genesis. Such interpretations did not square with the new scientific views of the cosmos such as the claim that the universe is infinitely large. Second, the Church was wary of those aspects of the “new science” Galileo represented that still mixed with magic and astrology. Third, these scientific findings upset much of the hitherto view of the cosmos that had undergirded the socio-political order the Church endorsed. Moreover, the new scientific views supported Calvinist views of determinism against the Catholic notion of free will. It took centuries before the Church officially rescinded its condemnation of Galileo.

b. Erasmus

Inspired by Greek humanism, Desiderius Erasmus placed a strong emphasis on the autonomy of human reason and the importance of moral precepts. As a Christian, he distinguished among three forms of law: laws of nature, thoroughly engraved in the minds of all men as St. Paul had argued, laws of works, and laws of faith. He was convinced that philosophers, who study laws of nature, could also produce moral precepts akin to those in Christianity. But Christian justification still comes ultimately only from the grace that can reveal and give a person the ability to follow the law of faith. As such, “faith cures reason, which has been wounded by sin.” So, while the laws of works are for the most part prohibitions against certain sins, the laws of faith tend to be positive duties, such as the injunctions to love one’s enemies and to carry one’s cross daily.

c. The Protestant Reformers

Martin Luther restricted the power of reason to illuminate faith. Like many reformers, he considered the human being alone unable to free itself from sin. In The Bondage of the Will, he makes a strict separation between what man has dominion over (his dealings with the lower creatures) and what God has dominion over (the affairs of His kingdom and thus of salvation). Reason is often very foolish: it immediately jumps to conclusions when it sees a thing happen once or twice. But by its reflections on the nature of words and our use of language, it can help us to grasp our own spiritual impotence.

Luther thus rejected the doctrine of analogy, developed by Aquinas and others, as an example of the false power of reason. In his Heidelberg Disputation Luther claims that a theologian must look only “on the visible rearward parts of God as seen in suffering and the cross.” Only from this perspective, do we keep our faith when we see, for example, that in the world the unjust prosper and the good undergo afflictions. Thus faith is primarily an act of trust in God’s grace.

Luther thus stresses the gratuitousness of salvation. In a traditional sense, Roman Catholics generally held that faith is meritorious, and thus that salvation involves good works. Protestant reformers like Luther, on the other hand, held that indeed faith is pure gift. He thus tended to make the hitherto Catholic emphasis on works look voluntaristic.

Like Luther, John Calvin appealed to the radical necessity of grace for salvation. This was embodied in his doctrine of election. But unlike Luther, Calvin gave a more measured response to the power of human reason to illuminate faith. In his Institutes of the Christian Religion, he argued that the human mind possesses, by natural instinct, an “awareness of divinity.” This sensus divinitatis is that whereby we form specific beliefs about God in specific situations, e.g. when experiencing danger, beauty, or even guilt. Even idolatry can contain as aspect of this. So religion is not merely arbitrary superstition. And yet, the law of creation makes necessary that we direct every thought and action to this goal of knowing God.

Despite this fundamental divine orientation, Calvin denied that a believer could build up a firm faith in Scripture through argument and disputation. He appealed instead to the testimony of Spirit embodied gained through a life of religious piety. Only through this testimony is certainty about one’s beliefs obtained. We attain a conviction without reasons, but only through “nothing other than what each believer experiences within himself–though my words fall far beneath a just explanation of the matter.” He realized, however, that “believers have a perpetual struggle with their own lack of faith.” But these struggles never remove them from divine mercy.

Calvin is thus an incompatibilist of the transrational type: faith is not against, but is beyond human reason.

d. Continental Rationalism

René Descartes, even more profoundly than Calvin, moved reason into the confines of the thinking subject. But he expanded the power of reason to grasp firmly the preambles of faith. In his Meditations, he claimed to have provided what amounted to be the most certain proofs of God possible. God becomes explicated by means of the foundation of subjective self-certainty. His proofs hinged upon his conviction that God cannot be a deceiver. Little room is left for faith.

Descartes’s thinking prepared Gottfried Leibniz to develop his doctrine of sufficient reason. Leibniz first argued that all truths are reducible to identities. From this it follows that a complete or perfect concept of an individual substance involves all its predicates, whether past, present, or future. From this he constructed his principle of sufficient reason: there is no event without a reason and no effect without a cause. He uses this not only to provide a rigorous cosmological proof for God’s existence from the fact of motion, but also to defend the cogency of both the ontological argument and the argument from design.

In his Theodicy Leibniz responded to Pierre Bayle, a French philosophe, who gave a skeptical critique of rationalism and support of fideism. First, Leibniz held that all truths are complementary, and cannot be mutually inconsistent. He argued that there are two general types of truth: those that are altogether necessary, since their opposite implies contradiction, and those that are consequences of the laws of nature. God can dispense only with the latter laws, such as the law of our mortality. A doctrine of faith can never violate something of the first type; but it can be in tension with truths of the second sort. Thus though no article of faith can be self-contradictory, reason may not be able to fully comprehend it. Mysteries, such as that of the Trinity, are simply “above reason.” But how do we weigh the probabilities favoring a doctrine of faith against those derived from general experience and the laws of nature? We must weigh these decisions by taking into account the existence and nature of God and the universal harmony by which the world is providentially created and ordered.

Leibniz insisted that one must respect the differences among the three distinct functions of reason: to comprehend, to prove, and to answer objections. In the faith/reason controversy, Leibniz thought that the third function takes on particular prominence. However, one sees vestiges of the first two as well, since an inquiry into truths of faith employs proofs of the infinite whose strength or weakness the reasoner can comprehend.

Baruch Spinoza, a Dutch philosopher, brought a distinctly Jewish perspective to his rigorously rationalistic analysis of faith. Noticing that religious persons showed no particular penchant to virtuous life, he decided to read the Scriptures afresh without any presuppositions. He found that Old Testament prophecy, for example, concerned not speculative but primarily practical matters. Obedience to God was one. He took this to entail that whatever remains effective in religion applies only to moral matters. He then claimed that the Scriptures do not conflict with natural reason, leaving it free reign. No revelation is needed for morality. Moreover, he was led to claim that though the various religions have very different doctrines, they are very similar to one another in their moral pronouncements.

e. Blaise Pascal

Pascal rejected the hitherto claims of medieval natural theologians, by claiming that reason can neither affirm nor deny God’s existence. Instead he focused on the way that we should act given this ambiguity. He argued that since the negative consequences of believing are few (diminution of the passions, some pious actions) but the gain of believing is infinite (eternal life), it is more rational to believe than to disbelieve in God’s existence. This assumes, of course, both that God would not grant eternal life to a non-believer and that sincerity in one’s belief in God is not a requirement for salvation. As such, Pascal introduced an original form of rational voluntarism into the analysis of faith.

f. Empiricism

John Locke lived at a time when the traditional medieval view of a unified body of articulate wisdom no longer seemed plausible. Yet he still held to the basic medieval idea that faith is assent to specific propositions on the basis of God’s authority. Yet unlike Aquinas, he argued that faith is not a state between knowledge and opinion, but a form of opinion (doxa). But he developed a kind of apology for Christianity: an appeal to revelation, without an appeal to enthusiasm or inspiration. His aim was to demonstrate the “reasonableness of Christianity.” Though faith and reason have “strict” distinct provinces, faith must be in accord with reason. Faith cannot convince us of what contradicts, or is contrary, to our knowledge. We cannot assent to a revealed proposition if it be contradictory to our clear intuitive knowledge. But propositions of faith are, nonetheless, understood to be “above reason.”

Locke specifies two ways in which matters of faith can be revealed: either though “original revelation” or “traditional revelation.” Moses receiving the Decalogue is an example of the former; his communication of its laws to the Israelites is an example of the latter. The truth of original revelation cannot be contrary to reason. But traditional revelation is even more dependent on reason, since if an original revelation is to be communicated, it cannot be understood unless those who receive it have already received a correlate idea through sensation or reflection and understood the empirical signs through which it is communicated.

For Locke, reason justifies beliefs, and assigns them varying degrees of probability based on the power of the evidence. But, like Aquinas, Locke held to the evidence not only of logical/mathematical and certain self-affirming existential claims, but also “that which is evident to the senses.” All of these veridical beliefs depend upon no other beliefs for their justification. But faith requires the even less certain evidence of the testimony of others. In the final analysis, faith’s assent is made not by a deduction from reason, but by the “credit of the proposer, as coming from God, in some extraordinary way of communication.” Thus Locke’s understands faith as a probable consent.

Locke also developed a version of natural theology. In An Essay Concerning Human Understanding he claims that the complex ideas we have of God are made of up ideas of reflection. For example, we take the ideas of existence, duration, pleasure, happiness, knowledge, and power and “enlarge every one of these with our idea of Infinity; and so putting them together, make our complex idea of God.” We cannot know God’s own essence, however.

David Hume, like Locke, rejected rationalism, but developed a more radical kind of empiricism than Locke had. He argued that concrete experience is “our only guide in reasoning concerning matters of fact.” Thus he rejected the possibility of arguing for the truths of faith on the basis either of natural theology or the evidence of miracles. He supported this conclusion on two grounds. First, natural theology requires certain inferences from everyday experience. The argument from design infers that we can infer a single designer from our experience of the world. Though Hume agrees that we have experiences of the world as an artifact, he claims that we cannot make any probable inference from this fact to quality, power, or number of the artisans. Second, Hume argues that miracles are not only often unreliable grounds as evidence for belief, but in fact are apriori impossible. A miracle by definition is a transgression of a law of nature, and yet by their very nature these laws admit of no exceptions. Thus we cannot even call it a law of nature that has been violated. He concludes that reason and experience fail to establish divine infinity, God’s moral attributes, or any specification of the ongoing relationship between the Deity and man. But rather than concluding that his stance towards religious beliefs was one of atheism or even a mere Deism, Hume argued that he was a genuine Theist. He believed that we have a genuine natural sentiment by which we long for heaven. The one who is aware of the inability of reason to affirm these truths in fact is the person who can grasp revealed truth with the greatest avidity.

g. German Idealism

Immanuel Kant was heavily influenced by Descartes’s anthropomorphism and Spinoza‘s and Jean Jacques Rousseau‘s restriction of the scope of religion to ethical matters. Moreover, he wanted a view that was consistent with Newton’s discoveries about the strict natural laws that govern the empirical world. To accomplish this, he steered the scope of reason away from metaphysical, natural, and religious speculation altogether.

Kant’s claim that theoretical reason was unable to grasp truths about God effectively continued the contraction of the authority of scienta in matters of faith that had been occurring since the late medieval period. He rejected, then, the timeless and spaceless God of revelation characteristic of the Augustinian tradition as beyond human ken. This is most evident in his critique of the cosmological proof for the existence of God in The Critique of Pure Reason. This move left Kant immune from the threat of unresolvable paradoxes. Nonetheless he did allow the concept of God (as well as the ideas of immortality and the soul) to become not a constitutive but a regulative ideal of reason. God’s existence remains a necessary postulate specifically for the moral law. God functions as the sources for the summum bonum. Only God can guarantee an ideal conformity of virtue and happiness, which is required to fulfill the principle that “ought implies can.” This grounded what Kant called a faith distinct from knowledge or comprehension, but nonetheless rational. Rational faith involves reliance neither upon God’s word nor the person of Christ, but only upon the recognition of God as the source of how we subjectively realize our duties. God is cause of our moral purposes as rational beings in nature. Yet faith is “free belief”: it is the permanent principle of the mind to assume as true, on account of the obligation in reference to it, that which is necessary to presuppose as condition of the possibility of the highest moral purpose. Like Spinoza, Kant makes all theology moral theology.

Since faith transcends the world of experience, it is neither doubtful nor merely probable. Thus Kant’s view of faith is complex: it has no theoretical grounds, yet it has a rational basis that provides more or less stable conviction for believers. He provided a religion grounded without revelation or grace. It ushered in new immanentism in rational views of belief.

G.W.F. Hegel, at the peak of German Idealism, took up Kant’s immanentism but moved it in a more radical direction. He claimed that in Kant, “philosophy has made itself the handmaid of a faith once more” though one not externally imposed but autonomously constituted. Hegel approved of the way Kant helped to modify the Enlightenment’s dogmatic emphasis on the empirical world, particularly as evidenced in the way Locke turned philosophy into empirical psychology. But though Kant held to an “idealism of the finite,” Hegel thought that Kant did not extend his idealism far enough. Kant’s regulative view of reason was doomed to regard faith and knowledge as irrevocably opposed. Hegel argued that a further development of idealism shows have faith and knowledge are related and synthesized in the Absolute.

Hegel reinterpreted the traditional proofs for God’s existence, rejected by Kant, as authentic expressions of the need of finite spirit to elevate itself to oneness with God. In religion this attempt to identify with God is accomplished through feeling. Feelings are, however, subject to conflict and opposition. But they are not merely subjective. The content of God enters feeling such that the feeling derives its determination from this content. Thus faith, implanted in one’s heart, can be defended by the testimony of the indwelling spirit of truth.

Hegel’s thoroughgoing rationalism ultimate yields a form of panentheism in which all finite beings, though distinct from natural necessity, have no existence independent from it. “There is only one Being… and things by their very nature form part of it.” God is the being in whom spirit and nature are united. Thus faith is merely an expression of a finitude comprehensible only from the rational perspective of the infinite. Faith is merely a moment in our transition to absolute knowledge.

6. The Nineteenth Century

Physics and astronomy were the primary scientific concerns for theologians in the seventeenth and eighteenth centuries. But in the nineteenth and twentieth centuries the sciences of geology, sociology, psychology, and biology became more pronounced.

Kant’s understanding of God as a postulate of practical reason – and his dismissal of metaphysical and empirical support for religion — soon led to the idea that God could be a mere projection of practical feeling or psychological impulse. Such an idea echoed Hobbes’s claim that religion arises from fear and superstition. Sigmund Freud claimed, for example, that religious beliefs were the result of the projection of a protective father figure onto our life situations. Although such claims about projection seem immune from falsification, the Freudian could count such an attempt to falsify itself simply as rationalization: a masking of a deeper unconscious drive.

The nineteenth century biological development most significant for theology was Charles Darwin’s theory of natural selection. It explained all human development on the basis simply of progressive adaptation or organisms to their physical environment. No reference to a mind or rational will was required to explain any human endeavor. Darwin himself once had believed in God and the immortality of the soul. But later he found that these could not count as evidence for the existence of God. He ended up an agnostic. On the one hand he felt compelled to affirm a First Cause of such an immense and wonderful universe and to reject blind chance or necessity, but on the other hand he remained skeptical of the capacities of humans “developed from a mind as low as that possessed by the lowest animals.” Such naturalistic views made it difficult to support any argument for God’s existence, particularly a design argument.

Not all nineteenth century scientific thinking, however, yielded skeptical conclusions. Emilé Durkheim, in his sociological study The Elementary Forms of Religious Life, took the scientific critiques of religion seriously, but gave them a much different interpretation. He concluded that the cultic practices of religion have the non-illusory quality of producing measurable good consequences in their adherents. Moreover, he theorized that the fundamental categories of thought, and even of science, have religious origins. Almost all the great social institutions were born of religion. He was lead to claim that “the idea of society is the soul of religion”: society derived from religious forces.

In the context of these various scientific developments, philosophical arguments about faith and reason developed in several remarkable directions in the nineteenth century.

a. Romanticism

Friedrich Schleiermacher was a liberal theologian who was quite interested in problems of biblical interpretation. He claimed that religion constituted its own sphere of experience, unrelated to scientific knowledge. Thus religious meaning is independent of scientific fact. His Romantic fideism would have a profound influence on Kierkegaard.

b. Socialism

Karl Marx is well known as an atheist who had strong criticisms of all religious practice. Much of his critique of religion had been derived from Ludwig Feuerbach, who claimed that God is merely a psychological projection meant to compensate for the suffering people feel. Rejecting wholesale the validity of such wishful thinking, Marx claimed not only that all sufferings are the result of economic class struggle but that they could be alleviated by means of a Communist revolution that would eliminate economic classes altogether. Moreover, Marx claimed that religion was a fundamental obstacle to such a revolution, since it was an “opiate” that kept the masses quiescent. Religious beliefs thus arise from a cognitive malfunction: they emerge from a “perverted world consciousness.” Only a classless communist society, which Marx thought would emerge when capitalism met its necessary demise, would eliminate religion and furnish true human emancipation.

c. Existentialism

Søren Kierkegaard, arguably the father of existentialism, was a profound religious thinker. He came up with an unequivocal view of faith and reason much like Tertullian’s strong incompatibilism. If Kant argued for religion within the limits of reason alone, Kierkegaard called for reason with the limits of religion alone. Faith requires a leap. It demands risk. All arguments that reason derives for a proof of God are in fact viciously circular: one can only reason about the existence of an object that one already assumes to exist. Hegel tried to claim that faith could be elevated to the status of objective certainty. Seeking such certainly, moreover, Kierkegaard considered a trap: what is needed is a radical trust. The radical trust of faith is the highest virtue one can reach.

Kierkegaard claimed that all essential knowledge intrinsically relates to an existing individual. In Either/Or, he outlined three general forms of life individuals can adopt: the aesthetic, ethical, and ethico-religious. The aesthetic is the life that seeks pleasure. The ethical is that which stresses the fulfillment of duties. Neither of these attains to the true individuality of human existence. But in the ethico-religious sphere, truth emerges in the authenticity of the relationship between a person and the object of his attention. With authenticity, the importance is on the “how,” not the “what,” of knowledge. It attains to a subjective truth, in which the sincerity and intensity of the commitment is key. This authenticity is equivalent to faith understood as “an objective uncertainty held fast in an appropriation-process of the most passionate inwardness.” The coexistence of this “objective uncertainty” with “passionate inwardness” is strikingly paradoxical. Kierkegaard makes a similarly paradoxical claim in holding that “nothing historical can become infinitely certain for me except the fact of my own existence (which again cannot become infinitely certain for any other individual, who has infinite certainty only of his own existence) and this is not something historical.” Thus faith can never be a matter of objective certainty; it involves no reckoning of probabilities, it is not an intellectual acceptance of a doctrine at all. Faith involves a submission of the intellect. It is not only hostile to but also completely beyond the grasp of reason.

Though he never read Kierkegaard, Friedrich Nietzsche came up with remarkable parallels to his thought. Both stressed the centrality of the individual, a certain disdain for public life, and a hatred of personal weakness and anonymity. They also both attacked certain hypocrisies in Christendom and the overstated praise for reason in Kant and Hegel. But Nietzsche had no part of Kierkegaard’s new Christian individual, and instead defended the aesthetic life disdained by Kierkegaard against both morality and Christianity. So he critique religion not from Kierkegaard’s epistemological perspective, but from a highly original moral perspective.

Nietzsche claimed that religion breeds hostility to life, understood broadly as will to power. Religion produces two types of character: a weak servile character that is at the same time strongly resentful towards those in power, and an Übermensch, or superman, who creates his own values. In The Joyful Wisdom Nietzsche proclaims that God as a protector of the weak, though once alive, is now dead, and that we have rightly killed him. Now, instead, he claims that we instead need to grasp the will to power that is part of all things and guides them to their full development completely within the natural world. For humans Nietzsche casts the will to power as a force of artistic and creative energy.

d. Catholic Apologists

Roman Catholics traditionally claimed that the task of reason was to make faith intelligible. In the later part of the nineteenth century, John Cardinal Newman worked to defend the power of reason against those intellectuals of his day who challenged its efficacy in matters of faith. Though maintaining the importance of reason in matters of faith, he reduces its ability to arrive at absolute certainties.

In his Grammar of Assent, Newman argued that one assents to God on the basis of one’s experience and principles. And one can do this by means of a kind of rational demonstration. And yet this demonstration is not actually reproducible by others; each of us has a unique domain of experience and expertise. Some are just given the capacity and opportunities to make this assent to what is demonstrated others are not. Drawing for Aristotle’s Nicomachean Ethics, Newman argues that “a special preparation of mind is required for each separate department of inquiry and discussion.” He stressed the continuity between religious belief and other kinds of belief that involve complex sets of phenomena. He claims that Locke, for example, overlooked how human nature actually works, imposing instead his own idea of how the mind is to act on the basis of deduction from evidence. If Locke would have looked more closely at experience, he would have noticed that much of our reasoning is tacit and informal. It cannot usually be reconstructed for a set of premises. Rather it is the accumulation of probabilities, independent of each other, arising out of the circumstances of the particular case. No specific consideration usually suffices to generate the required conclusion, but taken together, they may converge upon it. This is usually what is called a moral proof for belief in a proposition. In fact, we are justified in holding the beliefs even after we have forgotten what the warrant was. This probabilistic approach to religious assent continued in the later thinking of Basil Mitchell.

e. Pragmatism

William James followed in the pragmatist tradition inaugurated by Charles Sanders Peirce. Pragmatists held that all beliefs must be tested, and those that failed to garner sufficient practical value ought to be discarded.

In his Will to Believe, James was a strong critic of W.K. Clifford’s uncompromising empiricism. Clifford, like Hume, had argued that acting on beliefs or convictions alone, unsupported by evidence, was pure folly. He likened such acting to that of an irresponsible shipowner who allows an untrustworthy ship to be ready to set sail, merely thinking it safe, and then gives “benevolent wishes” for those who would set sail in it. Clifford concluded that we have a duty to act only on well founded beliefs. If we have no grounds for belief, we must suspend judgment. This provided the basis for an ethics of belief quite different than Newman’s. Clifford’s evidentialism inspired subsequent philosophers such as Bertrand Russell and Michael Scriven.

James argued, pace Clifford, that life would be severely impoverished if we acted only on completely well founded beliefs. Like Newman, James held that belief admits of a wide spectrum of commitment: from tentative to firm. The feelings that attach to a belief are significant. He defended the need we have, at times, to allow our “passional tendencies” to influence our judgments. Thus, like Pascal, he took up a voluntarist argument for religious belief, though one not dependent solely upon a wager. There are times, admittedly few, when we must act on our beliefs passionately held but without sufficient supporting evidence. These rare situations must be both momentous, once in a lifetime opportunities, and forced, such that the situation offers the agent only two options: to act or not to act on the belief. Religious beliefs often take on both of these characteristics. Pascal had realized the forced aspect of Christian belief, regarding salvation: God would not save the disbeliever. As a result, religion James claimed that a religious belief could be a genuine hypothesis for a person to adopt.

James does, however, also give some evidential support for this choice to believe. We have faith in many things in life — in molecules, conversation of energy, democracy, and so forth — that are based on evidence of their usefulness for us. But even in these cases “Our faith is faith in some one else’s faith.” Our mental life effectively comprises a constant interplay between volitions and beliefs. Nonetheless, James believed that while philosophers like Descartes and Clifford, not wanting to ever be dupes, focused primarily on the need to avoid error, even to the point of letting truth take its chance, he as an empiricist must hold that the pursuit of truth is paramount and the avoidance of error is secondary. His position entailed that that dupery in the face of hope is better than dupery in the face of fear.

In “The Sentiment of Rationality” James concludes that faith is “belief in something concerning which doubt is still theoretically possible; and as the test of belief is willingness to act, one may say that faith is the readiness to act in a cause the prosperous issue of which is not certified to us in advance.” So, faith is not only compatible with doubt, but it requires its possibility. Faith is oriented towards action: it is a kind of “working hypothesis” needed for practical life.

7. The Twentieth Century

Darwins’s scientific thesis of natural selection and Freud’s projective views of God continued to have a profound impact on many aspects of the philosophy of religion in the twentieth century. In fact the interplay between faith and reason began to be cast, in many cases, simply as the conflict between science and religion.

Not all scientific discoveries were used to invoke greater skepticism about the validity of religious claims, however. For example, in the late twentieth century some physicists endorsed what came to be called the anthropic principle. The principle derives from the claim of some physicists that a number of factors in the early universe had to coordinate in a highly statistically improbable way to produce a universe capable of sustaining advanced life forms. Among the factors are the mass of the universe and the strengths of the four basic forces (electromagnetism, gravitation, and the strong and weak nuclear forces). It is difficult to explain this fine tuning. Many who adhere to the anthropic principle, such as Holmes Rolston, John Leslie, and Stephen Hawking, argue that it demands some kind of extra-natural explanation. Some think it suggests possibilities for a new design argument for God’s existence. However, one can hold the anthropic principle and still deny that it has religious implications. It is possible to argue that it indicates not a single creator creating a single universe, but indeed many universes, either contemporaneous with our own or in succession to it.

The twentieth century witnessed numerous attempts to reconcile religious belief with new strands of philosophical thinking and with new theories in science.

a. Logical Positivism and Its Critics

Many philosophers of religion in the twentieth century took up a new appreciation for the scope and power of religious language. This was prompted to a large extent by the emphasis on conceptual clarity that dominated much Western philosophy, particularly early in the century.

This emphasis on conceptual clarity was evidenced especially in logical positivism. A.J. Ayer and Antony Flew, for example, argued that all metaphysical language fails to meet a standard of logical coherence and is thus meaningless. Metaphysical claims are not in principle falsifiable. As such, their claims are neither true nor false. They make no verifiable reference to the world. Religious language shares these characteristics with metaphysical language. Flew emphasized that religious believers generally cannot even state the conditions under which they would give up their faith claims. Since their claims then are unfalsifiable, they are not objects for rational determination.

One response by compatibilists to these arguments of logical positivists was to claim that religious beliefs, though meaningless in the verificational sense, are nonetheless important in providing the believer with moral motivations and self-understanding. This is an anti-realist understanding of faith. An example of this approach is found in R.M. Hare. Responding to Flew, he admitted that religious faith consists of a set of unfalsifiable assumptions, which he termed “bliks.” But Hare argued that our practical dealings with the everyday world involve numerous such “bliks.” Though some of these principles are faulty, we cannot but have some in order to live in the world.

Basil Mitchell responded to Flew’s claim that religious beliefs cannot be falsified. Mitchell argued that although rational and scientific considerations can and ought at times to prompt revisions of one’s religious belief, no one can give a general determination of exactly at what point a set of evidence ought to count decisively against a faith claim. It is up to each believer to decide when this occurs. To underscore this claim, Mitchell claimed that the rationality of religious beliefs ought to be determined not foundationally, as deductions from rational first principles, but collectively from the gathering of various types of evidence into a pattern. Nonetheless, he realized that this accumulation of evidence, as the basis for a new kind of natural theology, might not be strong enough to counter the skeptic. In the spirit of Newman, Mitchell concluded by defending a highly refined cumulative probabilism in religious belief.

Another reaction against logical positivism stemmed from Ludwig Wittgenstein. In his “Lectures on Religious Belief,” he argued that there is something unique about the linguistic framework of religious believers. Their language makes little sense to outsiders. Thus one has to share in their form of life in order to understand the way the various concepts function in their language games. The various language games form a kind of “family resemblance.” Wittgenstein concluded that those who demand a nonperspectival impartial way of assessing the truth value of a religious claim are asking for something impossible. From Wittgenstein’s perspective, science and religion are just two different types of language games. This demand to take on an internal perspective in order to assess religious beliefs commits Wittgenstein to a form of incompatibilism between faith and reason. Interpreters of Wittgenstein, like Norman Malcolm, claimed that although this entails that religious beliefs are essentially groundless, so are countless other everyday beliefs, such as in the permanence of our objects of perception, in the uniformity of nature, and even in our knowledge of our own intentions.

Wittgenstein, like Kierkegaard, claimed that proofs for God’s existence have little to do with actual belief in God. He did think that life itself could “educate” us about God’s existence. In Culture and Value he claims that sufferings can have a great impact on one’s beliefs. “These neither show us God in the way a sense impression shows us an object, nor do they give rise to conjectures about him. Experiences, thoughts–life can force this concept on us.” D.Z. Phillips also holds the view that religion has its own unique criteria for acceptable belief.

John Hick, in Faith and Knowledge, modifies the Wittgensteinian idea of forms of life to analyze faith claims in a novel manner. Hick claimed that this could shed light upon the epistemological (fides) analysis of faith. From such an analysis follows the non-epistemological thinking (fiducia) that guides actual practice.

Taking up the epistemological analysis, Hick first criticizes the voluntarisms of Pascal and James as “remote from the state of mind of such men as the great prophets.” He criticizes James in particular for reducing truth to utility. Hick argues instead for the importance of rational certainty in faith. He posits that there are as many types of grounds for rational certainty as there are kinds of objects of knowledge. He claims that religious beliefs share several crucial features with any empirical claim: they are propositional; they are objects of assent; an agent can have dispositions to act upon them; and we feel convictions for them when they are challenged. Nonetheless, Hick realizes that there are important ways in which sense beliefs and religious beliefs are distinct: sense perception is coercive, while religious perception is not; sense perception is universal, while religious is not; and sense perception is highly coherent within space and time, while religious awareness among different individuals is not. In fact, it may in fact be rational for a person who has not had experiences that compel belief to withhold belief in God.

From these similarities and differences between faith claims and claims of reason, Hick concludes that religious faith is the noninferential and unprovable basic interpretation either of a moral or religious “situational significance” in human experience. Faith is not the result of logical reasoning, but rather a profession that God “as a living being” has entered into the believer’s experience. This act of faith situates itself in the person’s material and social environment. Religious faith interprets reality in terms of the divine presence within the believer’s human experience. Although the person of faith may be unable to prove or explain this divine presence, his or her religious belief still acquire the status of knowledge similar to that of scientific and moral claims. Thus even if one could prove God’s existence, this fact alone would be a form of knowledge neither necessary nor sufficient for one’s faith. It would at best only force a notional assent. Believers live by not by confirmed hypotheses, but by an intense, coercive, indubitable experience of the divine.

Sallie McFague, in Models of God, argues that religious thinking requires a rethinking of the ways in which religious language employs metaphor. Religious language is for the most part neither propositional nor assertoric. Rather, it functions not to render strict definitions, but to give accounts. To say, for example, “God is mother,” is neither to define God as a mother nor to assert an identity between them, but rather to suggest that we consider what we do not know how to talk about–relating to God – through the metaphor of a mother. Moreover, no single metaphor can function as the sole way of expressing any aspect of a religious belief.

b. Philosophical Theology

Many Protestant and Roman Catholic theologians in the twentieth century responded to the criticisms of religious belief, leveled by atheistic existentialists, naturalists, and linguistic positivists, by forging a new understanding of Christian revelation.

Karl Barth, a Reformed Protestant, provided a startlingly new model of the relation between faith and reason. He rejected Schleiermacher’s view that the actualization of one’s religious motivation leads to some sort of established union between man and God. Barth argued instead that revelation is aimed at a believer who must receive it before it is a revelation. This means that one cannot understand a revelation without already, in a sense, believing it. God’s revelation of Himself, His very communication of that self, is not distinct from Himself. “In God’s revelation God’s Word is identical with God Himself” (in Church Dogmatics ii, I). Moreover, Barth claimed that God’s revelation has its reality and truth wholly and in every respect, both ontically and noetically, within itself. Revelation cannot be made true by anything else. The fullness of the “original self-existent being of God’s Word” reposes and lives in revelation. This renders the belief in an important way immune from both critical rational scrutiny and the reach of arguments from analogy.

Barth held, however, that relative to the believer, God remains “totally other” (totaliter aliter). Our selfhood stands in contradiction to the divine nature. Religion is, in fact, “unbelief”: our attempts to know God from our own standpoint are wholly and entirely futile. This was a consistent conclusion of his dialectical method: the simultaneous affirmation and negation of a given theological point. Barth was thus an incompatibilist who held that the ground of faith lies beyond reason. Yet he urged that a believer is nonetheless always to seek knowledge and that religious beliefs have marked consequences for daily life.

Karl Rahner, arguably the most influential Catholic theologian of the twentieth century, was profoundly influenced by Barth’s dialectical method. But Rahner argued that God’s mystical self-revelation of Himself to us through an act of grace is not predestined for a few but extends to all persons: it constitutes the “supernatural existential” that grounds all intelligibility and action. It lies beyond proof or demonstration. Thus all persons, living in this prior and often unthematized state of God’s gift, are “anonymous Christians.” All humans can respond to God’s self-communication in history. Rahner held thus that previous religions embodied a various forms of knowledge of God and thus were lawful religions. But now God has revealed his fullness to humans through the Christian Incarnation and word. This explicit self-realization is the culmination of the history of the previously anonymous Christianity. Christianity now understands itself as an absolute religion intended for all. This claim itself is basic for its understanding of itself.

Rahner’s claim about the gratuitous gifts of grace in all humans reaches beyond a natural theology. Nonetheless one form of evidence to which he appeals for its rational justification is the stipulation that humans, social by nature, cannot achieve a relationship to God “in an absolutely private interior reality.” The individual must encounter the natural divine law, not in his role as a “private metaphysician” but according to God’s will in a religious and social context. Rahner thus emphasized the importance of culture as a medium in which religious faith becomes understood. He thus forged a new kind of compatibilism between faith and rationality.

c. Neo-Existentialism

Paul Tillich, a German Protestant theologian, developed a highly original form of Christian apologetics. In his Systematic Theology, he laid out a original method, called correlation, that explains the contents of the Christian faith through existential questions and theological answers in mutual interdependence. Existential questions arise from our experiences of transitoriness, finitude, and the threat of nonbeing. In this context, faith is what emerges as our thinking about our “ultimate concern.” Only those who have had these kinds of experiences can raise the questions that open them to understand the meaning of the Christian message. Secular culture provides numerous media, such as poetry, drama, and novels, in which these questions are engendered. In turn, the Christian message provides unique answers to these questions that emerge from our human existence. Tillich realized that such an existentialist method – with its high degree of correlation between faith and everyday experience and thus between the human and the divine — would evoke protest from thinkers like Barth.

Steven Cahn approaches a Christian existentialism from less sociological and a more psychological angle than Tillich. Cahn agrees with Kierkegaard’s claim that most believers in fact care little about proofs for the existence of God. Neither naturalist nor supernaturalist religion depend upon philosophical proofs for God’s existence. It is impossible to prove definitely the testimony of another’s supposedly self-validating experience. One is always justified in entertaining either philosophical doubts concerning the logical possibility of such an experience or practical doubts as to whether the person has undergone it. Moreover, these proofs, even if true, would furnish the believer with no moral code. Cahn concludes that one must undergo a self-validating experience personal experience in which one senses the presence of God. All moral imperatives derive from learning the will of God. One may, however, join others in a communal effort to forge a moral code.

d. Neo-Darwinism

The Darwinistic thinking of the nineteenth century continued to have a strong impact of philosophy of religion. Richard Dawkins in his Blind Watchmaker, uses the same theory of natural selection to construct an argument against the cogency of religious faith. He argues that the theory of evolution by gradual but cumulative natural selection is the only theory that is in principle capable of explaining the existence of organized complexity in the world. He admits that this organized complexity is highly improbable, yet the best explanation for it is still a Darwinian worldview. Dawkins even claims that Darwin effectively solved the mystery of our own existence. Since religions remain firm in their conviction that God guides all biological and human development, Dawkins concludes that religion and science are in fact doomed rivals. They make incompatible claims. He resolves the conflict in favor of science.

e. Contemporary Reactions Against Naturalism and Neo-Darwinism

Contemporary philosophers of religion respond to the criticisms of naturalists, like Dawkins, from several angles.

Alvin Plantinga thinks that natural selection demonstrates only the function of species survival, not the production of true beliefs in individuals. Yet he rejects traditional Lockean evidentialism, the view that a belief needs adequate evidence as a criterion for its justification. But he refuses to furnish a fideist or existentialist condition for the truth of religious beliefs. Rather he claims that religious beliefs are justified without reasons and are, as such, “properly basic.” These he sets in contrast to the claims of natural theology to form the basis of his “Reformed epistemology.” Other Reformed epistemologists are W.P Alston and Nicholas Wolterstorff.

Plantinga builds his Reformed epistemology by means of several criticisms of evidentialism. First, the standards of evidence in evidentialism are usually set too high. Most of our reliable everyday beliefs are not subject to such strict standards. Second, the set of arguments that evidentialists attack is traditionally very narrow. Plantinga suggest that they tend to overlook much of what is internally available to the believer: important beliefs concerning beauty and physical attributes of creatures, play and enjoyment, morality, and the meaning of life. Third, those who employ these epistemological criticisms often fail to realize that the criticisms themselves rest upon auxiliary assumptions that are not themselves epistemological, but rather theological, metaphysical, or ontological. Finally, and more importantly, not all beliefs are subject to such evidence. Beliefs in memories or other minds, for example, generally appeal to something properly basic beyond the reach of evidence. What is basic for a religious belief can be, for example, a profound personal religious experience. In short, being self-evident, incorrigible, or evident to the senses is not a necessary condition of proper basicality. We argue to what is basic from below rather than from above. These claims are tested by a relevant set of “internal markers.” Plantinga does admit that in fact no widespread acceptance of the markers can be assumed. He concludes, though, that religious believers cannot be accused of shirking some fundamental epistemic duty by relying upon this basic form of evidence.

Epistemological views such as Plantinga develops entail that there is an important distinction between determining whether or not a religious belief is true (de facto) and whether or not one ought to hold or accept it (de jure). On de jure grounds, for example, one can suggest that beliefs are irrational because they are produced either by a errant process or by an proper process aimed at the wrong aim or end. Theism has been criticized on both of these grounds. But since Christianity purports to be true, the de jure considerations must reduce ultimately to de facto considerations.

J.J. Haldane criticizes the scientific critiques of religion on the grounds that they themselves make two unacknowledged assumptions about reality: the existence of regular patterns of interaction, and the reality of stable intelligences in humans. These assumptions themselves cannot be proven by scientific inquiry. Thus it seems odd to oppose as rivals scientific and religious ways of thinking about reality. Science itself is faith-like in resting upon these assumptions; theology carries forward a scientific impulse in asking how the order of the world is possible. But what do we make of the fact that scientific models often explain the world better than religious claims? What troubles Haldane is the explanatory reductionism physical sciences employ is often thought to be entailed by the ontological reduction it assumes. For example, the fact that one can give a complete description of human action and development on a biological level alone is often thought to mean that all action and development can be explained according to biological laws. Haldane rejects this thesis, arguing that certain mental events might be ontologically reducible to physical events, but talk of physical events cannot be equally substituted for mental events in the order of explanation. Such argumentation reflects the general direction of the anomological monism proposed by Donald Davidson. Haldane concludes that language can be a unique source of explanatory potential for all human activity.

Like Haldane, Nancey Murphy also holds for a new form of compatibilism between religion and science. In Science and Theology she argues that the differences between scientific and theological methodologies are only of degree, not kind. She admits that scientific methodology has fundamentally changed the way we think about the world. Consequently, theology in the modern period has been preoccupied with the question of theological method. But she thinks that theological method can develop to meet the same standard of criteria as scientific method has.

Scientific thinking in the twentieth century in particular has been developing away from foundationalism: the derivation of theories from indubitable first principles. Willard van Orman Quine and others urged that scientific methodologists give up on foundationalism. He claimed that knowledge is like a web or net of beliefs: some beliefs are simply more apt to be adopted or rejected in certain situations than others are. Murphy sees that theology, too, is developing away from the foundationalism that literal interpretations of Scripture used to provide. Now it tends to emphasize the importance of religious experience and the individual interpretation of beliefs. But two problems await the move from theology away from foundationalism: subjectivism and circularity. The subjectivism emerges from the believer’s inability to make the leap from his or her private inner experience to the real world. The circularity emerges from the lack of any kind of external check on interpretation. Alasdair MacIntyre is concerned with the latter problem. He claims that evidence for belief requires a veridical experience for each subsequent belief that arises from it. But Murphy finds this approach still close to foundationalism. Instead she develops two non-foundational criteria for the interpretation of a religious belief: that several related but differing experiences give rise to the belief, and that the belief have publicly observable consequences emanating from it.

To illustrate this approach to interpretation of beliefs, Murphy considers Catherine of Siena’s claim that a true “verification” of a revelation from God requires that the believer subsequently engage in publicly observable acts of humility and charity. The verification also requires what Murphy calls discernment. Discernment reveals analogous experiences and interpretations in other believers and a certain reliability in the actions done. It functions the same way that a theory of instrumentation does in science. Discernment often takes place within a community of some sort.

But are these beliefs, supported by this indirect verification and communal discernment, still in any sense falsifiable? Murphy notes that religious experience has clashed with authoritative theological doctrine numerous times. But it has also ended up correcting it, for example in the way that Catherine of Siena’s writings eventually changed the Roman Catholic tradition in which she was writing.

Murphy claims, however, that until theology takes on the status as a kind of knowledge of a reality independent of the human subject it is unlikely that theology and science will have a fruitful dialogue. But she thinks that turning from the subjectivization of the liberal turn in theology to discourse about human religiosity will help this dialogue.

A strong critic of the negative impact of scientific naturalism on faith is the Canadian philosopher Charles Taylor. Taylor finds in all naturalisms a kind of “exclusive humanism” that not only puts humans at the center of the universe, but denies them any authentic aspirations to goals or states beyond the world in which they live. In modernity naturalism has led inexorably to secularization. In Sources of the Self, Taylor argues that secularization, inspired by both Luther and Calvin, first resulted in the prioritizing of “ordinary life” of marriage and family over that of contemplative lives in the vowed or clerical state. In later phases it led to the transformation of cultural practices into forms that are neutral with regard to religious affiliation. But secularization is not a prima facie problem for any religious believer, since it does not preclude the possibility of religious faith or practices per se. Moreover, secularization has made possible the development of legal and governmental structures, such as human rights, better fit for pluralistic societies containing persons of a number of different religious faiths. Thus it has made it easier for Christians to accept full rights for atheists or violators of the Christian moral code. Nonetheless, Taylor sees problems that secularism poses for the Christian faith. It can facilitate a marriage between the Christian faith and a particular form of culture.

In contrast to naturalism, Taylor urges the adoption of a unique transcendental point of view. Such a view does not equate a meaningful life with a full or good life. Instead, a transcendental view finds in suffering and death not only something that matters beyond life, but something from which life itself originally draws. Thus natural life is to be subordinated to the “abundant life” that Jesus advocates in his Good Shepherd discourse (John 10:10). This call of the transcendental requires, ultimately, a conversion or a change of identity. This is a transition from self-centeredness, a kind of natural state, to God-centeredness. Unable to find value in suffering and death, those who focus on ordinary life try assiduously to avoid them. The consequences of this resistance to the transcendent, found in this uncritical embrace of ordinary life, are not so much epistemic as moral and spiritual. Ordinary life virtues emphasize benevolence and solidarity. But modern individuals, trying to meet these demands, experience instead a growing sense of anger, futility, and even contempt when confronted with the disappointments of actual human performance. This is ordinary life’s “dialectics of reception.” A transcendental vision, on the other hand, opens up a future for humans that is not a matter of guarantee, but only faith. It is derived from “standing among others in the stream” of God’s unconditional love.

The theological principle by which Taylor buttresses this vision is that “Redemption happens through Incarnation.” The incarnational and natural “ordinary” requires always the call of a redemptive “beyond” that is the object of our endeavors inspired by faith and hope.

f. Liberation Theology

Liberation theologians, such as Juan Segundo and Leonardo Boff, have drawn their inspiration from the plight of the poverty and injustice of peoples in the Third World, particularly Latin American. Drawing from Marx’s distinction between theory and practice, Gustavo Gutiérrez, in A Theology of Liberation, argues that theology is critical reflection on the socio-cultural situation in which belief takes place. Ultimately theology is reactive: it does not produce pastoral practice, but it finds the Spirit either present or absent in current practices. The reflection begins by examining the faith of a people is expressed through their acts of charity: their life, preaching, and historical commitment of the Church. The reflection also draws from the totality of human history. In a second moment, the reflection provides resources for new practices. Thus it protects the faith of the people from uncritical practices of fetishism and idolatry. Theology thus plays a prophetic role, by interpreting historical events with the intention of revealing and proclaiming their profound meaning.

8. References and Further Reading

• Alston, William. “History of Philosophy of Religion.” The Routledge Encyclopedia of Philosophy. Vol. 8. Ed. E. Craig. New York: Routledge, 1998. Pp. 238-248.
  • This article provides a good basic outline of the problem of faith and reason.
• Asimov, Isaac. Asimov’s Biographical Encyclopedia of Science and Technology. Garden City NY: Doubleday, 1964.
  • Much of the above section of Galileo comes from this text.
• Copleston, Frederick. Medieval Philosophy. New York: Harper, 1952.
• Helm, Paul, ed. Faith and Reason. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1999.
  • This text has an excellent set of readings and good introductions to each section. Some of the above treatment of the introductions to each period are derived from it.
• McInerny, Ralph. St. Thomas Aquinas. Boston: Twayne, 1977.
• McGrath, Alister, ed. The Christian Theology Reader. Oxford: Basil Blackwell, 1995.
  • This text provided some of the above material on early Christian philosophers.
• Meagher, Paul, Thomas O’Brien and Consuelo Aherne, eds. Encyclopedic Dictionary of Religion. 3 Vols. Washington DC: Corpus Publications, 1979.
• Murphy, Nancey. “Religion and Science.” The Routledge Encyclopedia of Philosophy. Vol. 8. Ed. E. Craig.. New York: Routledge, 1998. Pp. 230-236
• Murphy, Nancey. Theology in the Age of Scientific Reasoning. Ithaca NY: Cornell University Press, 1990.
• Peterson, Michael, William Hasker, Bruce Reichenback, David Basinger. Philosophy of Religion: Selected Readings. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2001.
  • This text was helpful for the above treatments of Richard Dawkins and Nancey Murphy.
• Plantinga, Alvin. “Religion and Epistemology.” The Routledge Encyclopedia of Philosophy. Vol. 8. Ed. E. Craig. London/New York: Routledge, 1998. Pp. 209-218.
• Pojman, Louis, ed. Philosophy of Religion: An Anthology. 2^nd ed. Belmont CA.: Wadsworth, 1994.
  • This text provides a good introduction to the philosophy of religion. Some of the above treatments of Kant, Pascal, Plantinga, Cahn, Leibniz, Flew, Hare, Mitchell, Wittgenstein, and Hick are derived from its summaries.
• Pomerleau, Wayne. Western Philosophies of Religion. New York, Ardsley House, 1998.
  • This text serves as the basis for much of the above summaries of Augustine, Aquinas, Descartes, Locke, Leibniz, Hume, Kant, Hegel, Kierkegaard, James, Wittgenstein, and Hick.
• Rolston, Holmes III. Science and Religion: A Critical Survey. New York: Random House, 1987.
  • This has a good section on the anthropic principle.
• Solomon, Robert, ed. Existentialism. New York: The Modern Library, 1974.
• Taylor, Charles. A Catholic Modernity? Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1999.
• Taylor, Charles. Sources of the Self. Cambridge MA.: Harvard University Press, 1989.
• Wolterstoff, Nicholas. “Faith.” The Routledge Encyclopedia of Philosophy. Vol. 3. Ed. E. Craig. London: Routledge, 1998. Pp. 538-544.
  • This text formed the basis for much of the above treatment of “Reformed Epistemology.

Author Information

James Swindal
Email: swindalj@duq.edu
Duquesne University
U. S. A.

Natural Theology

Natural theology is a program of inquiry into the existence and attributes of God without referring or appealing to any divine revelation. In natural theology, one asks what the word “God” means, whether and how names can be applied to God, whether God exists, whether God knows the future free choices of creatures, and so forth. The aim is to answer those questions without using any claims drawn from any sacred texts or divine revelation, even though one may hold such claims.

For purposes of studying natural theology, Jews, Christians, Muslims, and others will bracket and set aside for the moment their commitment to the sacred writings or traditions they believe to be God’s word. Doing so enables them to proceed together to engage in the perennial questions about God using the sources of evidence that they share by virtue of their common humanity, for example, sensation, reason, science, and history. Agnostics and atheists, too, can engage in natural theology. For them, it is simply that they have no revelation-based views to bracket and set aside in the first place.

This received view of natural theology was a long time in the making. Natural theology was born among the ancient Greeks, and its meeting with ancient Judeo-Christian-Muslim thought constituted a complex cultural event. From that meeting there developed throughout the Middle Ages for Christians a sophisticated distinction between theology in the Christian sense and natural theology in the ancient Greek sense. Although many thinkers in the Middle Ages tried to unite theology and natural theology into a unity of thought, the project frequently met with objections, as we shall see below. The modern era was partly defined by a widespread rejection of natural theology for both philosophical and theological reasons. Such rejection persisted, and persists, although there has been a significant revival of natural theology in recent years.

Table of Contents

1. Historical Beginnings of Theology and Philosophy
2. Ancient Philosophy and the First Principle
3. Ancient Jewish and Early Christian Theology
4. Distinction between Revealed Theology and Natural Theology
5. Thomas Aquinas
6. Modern Philosophy and Natural Theology
7. Natural Theology Today
8. References and Further Reading
   1. Primary Sources
      1. Ancient Mediaeval Theology
      2. Mediaeval Natural Theology
      3. Modern Natural Theology
      4. Contemporary Natural Theology
   2. Secondary Sources

1. Historical Beginnings of Theology and Philosophy

The story of natural theology begins where theology begins. For the Greeks the term theology originally referred to inquiry into the lives and activities of the gods or divinities. In the Greek world, theology and mythology were the same concept. The theologians were the poets whose task it was to present accounts of the gods in poetic form. In the same age when the gods dominated popular thinking, however, another movement was growing: philosophy. The first philosophers, the pre-Socratics, undertook a quest to find the first principle of things. “First principle” here means the ultimate source or origin of all things. The pre-Socratic quest is often described as “purely rational” in the sense that it proceeded without making reference or appeal to the authority of poets or stories of the gods. The pre-Socratic philosophers entertained various candidates as to the first principle, for example, water, fire, conflicting dualities, number, or simply “being.” Both the mythology of the gods (already defined by the name of theology) and the purely rational quest for the first principle (later defined by the name of philosophy) constituted the cultural heritage of Plato and Aristotle – the two thinkers who would most greatly influence the development of natural theology. Plato and Aristotle each recognized the distinction between the two ways of inquiring into ultimate truth: the poetic-mythological-theological way and the purely rational way.

2. Ancient Philosophy and the First Principle

Plato (427 – 347 B.C.E.) in his well-known “Allegory of the Cave” in Book VII of The Republic, provides an image of what education consists in. True education consists in being led from the bondage of sensory appearances into the light of knowledge afforded by the form of the Good. The form of the Good is the cause of all being and all knowledge (the first principle). Knowledge of the form of the Good is arrived at through the struggle of dialectical argumentation. The dialectical arguments of philosophy do not prove the existence of the form of the Good, but contribute to inducing a non-inferential perception of it. Although Plato himself does not identify the form of the Good as God, later thinkers surely did.

Aristotle (384 – 322 B.C.E.) offers arguments for the existence of God (a God beyond the gods so to speak). Aristotle’s arguments start from the observable fact of motion or change in things around us. On the basis of his theory of motion, change, and causality presented in Physics, Aristotle proceeds to offer a demonstration that there exists a first mover of all other movers which is not itself moved in any respect. The first, unmoved mover is a postulate intended to account for the perpetuity of motion and change around us. The “argument from motion” is not meant to be a dialectical exercise that induces non-inferential perception of God, but a demonstration or proof according to the canons of proof that Aristotle presents in the Posterior Analytics. In the later books of Metaphysics, Aristotle goes further and identifies the unmoved mover as separated from matter and as nous or Mind. It is thought thinking itself. On Aristotle’s view, even though the world is everlasting, all things everlastingly proceed in accord with separated Reason: the first principle of all. Both Plato and Aristotle have one view in common. They hold that through a form of rational argumentation (whether it be demonstrative or dialectical), one can – without appeal to the authority of sacred writings – arrive at some knowledge or awareness of a first principle that is separated from matter.

We have now come to call the development of this non-poetic or non-mythological form of thought from the pre-Socratics through Plato and Aristotle by the name of “philosophy.” Aristotle’s arguments for the existence of God, because they argued from some feature of nature, came to be called “natural theology.” Natural theology was part of philosophy, as opposed to being part of the mytho-poetic theology.

3. Ancient Jewish and Early Christian Theology

As philosophy was developing from the Pre-Socratics through to Plato and Aristotle, another development was taking place among the Israelites or the ancient Jews. What was developing was their understanding of their corporate identity as the chosen people of God (YHWH). They conceived of themselves as a people established in a covenant with him, and bound to serve him according to the law and ritual prescriptions they had received from him. Texts received as sacred and as the word of God were an essential basis for their life, practice and thought.

It was among Jews and as a Jew that Jesus of Nazareth was born, lived his life, and gathered his first adherents. Christianity shared with Judaism a method for approaching God that essentially involved texts and faith in them as God’s word (although Christianity would eventually involve more texts than ancient Judaism). As Christianity spread, so did its faith-based and text-based method for approaching an understanding of God. As a minority practice within a predominantly Roman-Hellenistic culture, Christianity soon faced two new questions. First, do Christians have a “theology?”Second, what should a Christian make of “philosophy?” So long as Christianity remained a minority practice, Christians themselves remained conflicted on how to answer the two questions posed by the predominant culture.

The first question – do Christians have a theology? – was difficult for Christians to answer due to the poetic-mythological sense of the term “theology” still prevalent in the predominant Roman-Hellenistic milieu. All Christians rejected the views of the mythological-poets (the theologians). So long as the word “theology” meant the pagan mythological poetry and worship of the gods as practiced in the prevailing culture, Christians rejected the word “theology” as well. But once Christianity became culturally predominant, the word “theology” could and did become disassociated from the belief in and worship of the gods and was applied instead to the specifically Christian task of thinking and speaking about God as revealed in the Christian Scriptures. Under the new conditions, Christians found themselves more widely capable of saying that they had a theology.

The second question – what should Christians make of philosophy? – was difficult for Christians to answer because in the name of “philosophy” Christianity met with strong resistance to its central claims, for example, that Jesus is the Word made flesh. Some Christians considered philosophy essentially incompatible with Christianity; other Christians considered the possibility of a sort of intellectual alliance between philosophy and Christianity. On the one hand, Tertullian (160 – 220) famously quipped “What has Athens to do with Jerusalem?” (Prescription Against the Heretics, ch. VII). He is often quoted to show (perhaps unfairly) that he and Christians of his age rejected philosophical or “purely rational” methods for approaching knowledge of God. On the other hand, some Christians who were roughly his contemporaries happily availed themselves of contemporary philosophical vocabulary, concepts, and reasoning to expound Christian teaching. For example, Justin the Martyr (100-165), a convert to Christianity from Platonism, developed an account of the activity of Christ in terms of a medley of Platonist and Stoic ideas. Clement of Alexandria developed an account of Christian knowledge (gnosis) based on a variety of ideas drawn from prevalent philosophies. Greek speaking eastern Christians (more quickly than Latin speaking ones) began a process of borrowing, altering, and then using prevalent philosophical categories to corroborate and clarify their faith-based views of God. Their writings are filled with discussions of God’s existence and attributes in terms that are recognizable to philosophers. But is philosophical thought that has been used to clarify and corroborate faith-based and text-based beliefs still philosophical thought? Philosophy, after all, proceeds without appeal to the authority of sacred texts, and Christian theology proceeded by way of appeal to Christian sacred texts. There was now need for a new degree of precision regarding the ways to arrive at knowledge of God.

4. Distinction between Revealed Theology and Natural Theology

The distinction between revealed theology and natural theology eventually grew out of the distinction between what is held by faith and what is held by understanding or reason. St. Augustine, in describing how he was taught as a catechumen in the Church, writes:

“From this time on, however, I gave my preference to the Catholic faith. I thought it more modest and not in the least misleading to be told by the Church to believe what could not be demonstrated – whether that was because a demonstration existed but could not be understood by all or whether the matter was not one open to rational proof…You [God] persuaded me that the defect lay not with those who believed your books, which you have established with such great authority amongst almost all nations, but with those who did not believe them.” Confessions Bk. VI, v (7). (Chadwick, 1992)

Here Augustine describes being asked to believe certain things, that is, take them on authority, even though they could not be demonstrated. The distinction between what one takes on authority (particularly the authority of Scripture) and what one accepts on the basis of demonstration runs throughout the corpus of Augustine’s writings. These two ways of holding claims about God correspond roughly with things one accepts by faith and things that proceed from understanding or reason. Each of the two ways will produce a type of theology. The program for inquiring into God on the basis of faith/text-commitments will be called “revealed theology” many centuries later. Also, the program for inquiring about God strictly on the basis of understanding or reason will be called “natural theology” many centuries later. The distinction between holding something by faith and holding it by reason, as well as the distinction between the two types of theology that each way produces, can be traced through some major figures of the Middle Ages. Two examples follow.

First, Anicius Manlius Severinus Boethius (480 – 524) presented an elaborate account of God’s existence, attributes, and providence. Although a Christian, Boethius brings together in his Consolation of Philosophy the best of various ancient philosophical currents about God. Without any appeal to the authority of Christian Scripture, Boethius elaborated his account of God as eternal, provident, good, and so forth.

Second, Pseudo-Dionysius (late 5th century) also raised the distinction between knowing things from the authority of Scripture and knowing them from rational arguments:

“Theological tradition has a dual aspect, the ineffable and mysterious on the one hand, the open and more evident on the other. The one resorts to symbolism and involves initiation. The other is philosophic and employs the method of demonstration.” Epistola IX (Luibheid, 1987)

Here we have the distinction between the two ways of approaching God explicitly identified as two aspects of theology. Augustine, Boethius, and Pseudo-Dionysius (to name but a few) thus make possible a more refined distinction between two types of aspects to theology. On the one hand, there is a program of inquiry that aims to understand what one accepts in faith as divine revelation from above. On the other hand, there is a program of inquiry that proceeds without appeal to revelation and aims to obtain some knowledge of God from below.

The eighth to the twelfth centuries are often considered the years of monastic theology. During this time, Aristotle’s writings in physics and metaphysics were lost to the West, and the knowledge of Platonism possessed by earlier Christians waned. The speculative ambitions of earlier Christian theologians (for example, Origen, Augustine, the Cappadocians, and so forth) were succeeded by the tendency of the monks to meditate upon, but not to speculate beyond, the Scriptures and the theological tradition received from earlier Christians. The monk aimed primarily at experiencing what the texts revealed about God rather than to understanding what the texts revealed about God in terms afforded by reason and philosophy (see LeClerq, 1982). This began to change with Anselm of Canterbury (1033 – 1109).

Anselm is best known in contemporary philosophical circles for his ontological argument for the existence of God. As the argument is commonly understood, Anselm aimed to show that God exists without making appeal to any sacred texts and also without basing his argument upon any empirical or observable truth. The argument consists entirely of an analysis of the idea of God, and a tracing of the implications of that idea given the laws of logic, for example, the principle of non-contradiction. Anselm, however, is known among medieval specialists for much more. Although a monk himself, he is known as the first to go beyond the purely meditative and experiential aims of monastic theology, and to pursue a serious speculative ambition. He wished to find the necessary reasons for why God acted as he has in history (as revealed by the Bible). Although Anselm’s program was still a matter of Christian faith seeking to understand God as revealed by the Bible and grasped by faith, Anselm helped legitimize once again the use of reason for speculating upon matters held by faith. Once the writings of Aristotle in Physics and Metaphysics were recovered in the West, the question inevitably arose as to what to make of Aristotelian theses vis-à-vis views held on Christian faith. There arose a need for a new degree of precision on the relationship between philosophy and theology, faith and understanding. One classic account to provide that precision came from Thomas Aquinas who had at his disposal many centuries of preliminary reflection on the issues.

5. Thomas Aquinas

In the work of Thomas Aquinas (1225 – 1276), one finds two distinctions that serve to clarify the nature and status of natural theology. Aquinas distinguishes between two sorts of truths and between two ways of knowing them.

For Aquinas, there are two sorts of truths about God:

“There is a twofold mode of truth in what we profess about God. Some truths about God exceed all the ability of human reason. Such is the truth that God is triune. But there are some truths which the natural reason also is able to reach. Such are the truth that God exists, that he is one, and the like. In fact, such truths about God have been proved demonstratively by the philosophers, guided by the light of natural reason.” (SCG I, ch.3, n.2)

On the one hand, there are truths beyond the capacity of the human intellect to discover or verify and, on the other hand, there are truths falling within the capacity of human intellect to discover and verify. Let us call the first sort truths beyond reason and the latter sort truths of natural reason. There are different ways of knowing or obtaining access to each sort of truth.

The truths of natural reason are discovered or obtained by using the natural light of reason. The natural light of reason is the capacity for intelligent thought that all human beings have just by virtue of being human. By exercising their native intelligence, human beings can discover, verify, and organize many truths of natural reason. Aquinas thinks that human beings have discovered many such truths and he expects human beings to discover many more. Although there is progress amidst the human race in understanding truths of natural reason, Aquinas thinks there are truths that are totally beyond the intelligence of the entire human race.

The truths beyond reason are outside the aptitude of the natural light of reason to discover or verify. The cognitive power of all humanity combined, all humanity of the past, present, and future, does not suffice to discover or verify one of the truths beyond reason. How then does an individual or humanity arrive at such truths? Humanity does not arrive at them. Rather, the truths arrive at humanity from a higher intellect – God. They come by way of divine revelation, that is, by God testifying to them. God testifies to them in a three-step process.

First, God elevates the cognitive powers of certain human beings so that their cognitive powers operate at a level of aptitude beyond what they are capable of by nature. Thanks to the divinely enhanced cognition, such people see more deeply into things than is possible for humans whose cognition has not been so enhanced. The heightened cognition is compared to light, and is often said to be a higher light than the light of natural reason. It is called the light of prophecy or the light of revelation. The recipients of the light of prophecy see certain things that God sees but that the rest of humanity does not. Having seen higher truths in a higher light, the recipients of the higher light are ready for the second step.

Second, God sends those who see things in the higher light to bear witness and to testify to what they see in the higher light. By so testifying, the witnesses (the prophets and Apostles of old) served as instruments or a mouthpiece through which God made accessible to humanity some of those truths that God sees but that humanity does not see. Furthermore, such truths were then consigned to Scripture (by the cognitively enhanced or “inspired” authors of the books of the Bible), and the Bible was composed. The Bible makes for the third step.

Third, in the present God uses the Bible as a current, active instrument for teaching the same truths to humanity. By accepting in faith God speaking through the Bible, people today have a second-hand knowledge of certain truths that God alone sees first-hand. Just as God illuminated the prophets and apostles in the light of prophecy to see what God alone sees, God also illuminates people today to have faith in God speaking through the Bible. This illumination is called the light of faith.

Just as one sees certain claims of natural reason by the light of natural reason, so the Christian faith hold certain claims beyond reason by the God-given light of faith. In the thought of Thomas Aquinas, the traditional distinction between two domains of truths and the distinctive way of knowing truth in each domain, reaches a point of clarity. This distinction is at the basis of the distinction between theology and natural theology.

Theology (in the Thomistic sense), as it later came to be called, is the program for inquiring by the light of faith into what one believes by faith to be truths beyond reason that are revealed by God. Natural theology, as it later came to be called, is the program for inquiring by the light of natural reason alone into whatever truths of natural reason human beings might be able to find about God. Theology and natural theology differ in what they inquire into, and in what manner they inquire. What theology inquires into is what God has revealed himself to be. What natural theology inquires into is what human intelligence can figure out about God without using any of the truths beyond reason, that is, the truths divinely revealed. Theology proceeds by taking God’s revelation as a given and using one divinely revealed truth to account for another divinely revealed truth (or to give a higher account of truths of natural reason). Natural theology proceeds by bracketing and setting aside God’s revelation and seeking to discover, verify, and organize truths of natural reason about God. Aquinas’s distinctions remain the historical source of how many contemporary theologians and philosophers characterize the differences of their respective disciplines.

To see how theology and natural theology differ for Aquinas, it may help to look into faith and theology in more detail. One seems blind in accepting on faith the truths of revelation found in the Bible. They seem blind because faith is a way of knowing something second-hand. A faithful person is in the position of believing what another intellect (the divine intellect) sees. Now although one does not see for oneself the truths accepted in faith, one desires to see them for oneself. Faith tends to prompt intellectual questioning, inquiry, and seeking into the meaning and intelligibility of the mystery held in faith. Why did God create the world? Why does God allow so much suffering? Why did God become Incarnate? Why did he have to die on a cross to save humanity? Many more questions come up. One asks questions of the truths of divine revelation without doubting those truths. On the contrary, one raises such questions because in faith one is confident that one truth of divine revelation can explain another truth of divine revelation. The truth of the Trinity’s purposes in creating us, for example, can explain the Incarnation. Thus, one questions the faith in faith. The project of questioning the faith in faith, finding answers, organizing them, justifying them, debating them, seeking to understanding “the why” and so forth is called theology.

Natural theology, on the other hand, does not presuppose faith as theology does. Natural theology does not attempt to explain truths beyond reason such as the Incarnation or the Trinity, and it certainly does not attempt to base anything on claims made in the Bible. Rather, natural theology uses other sources of evidence. Natural theology appeals to empirical data and the deliverances of reason to search out, verify, justify, and organize as much truth about God as can be figured out when one limits oneself to just these sources of evidence.

Aquinas practiced both theology and natural theology. Furthermore, he blended the two rather freely, and blended them into a unified architectonic wisdom. His architectonic contains both theology and natural theology (sometimes they are difficult to sort out).

Aquinas is primarily a theologian and his best-known work is his Summa Theologica. Aquinas saw himself as using truths of natural reason to help understand truths of divine revelation. Consequently, as part of his theology, Aquinas presents and refines many philosophical arguments (truths of natural reason) that he had inherited from multiple streams of his culture: Aristotle, Augustine, Boethius, Pseudo-Dionysius, Muslim philosophers and commentators on Aristotle, and the Jewish Rabbi Moses Maimonides. Aquinas saw himself as taking all the truth they had discovered and using it all to penetrate the meaning and intelligibility of what God is speaking through the bible.

In his Summa Contra Gentiles, Aquinas presents in lengthy detail a series of philosophical demonstrations of the existence of God, philosophical demonstrations of a variety of divine attributes, a philosophical theory of naming God, as well as multiple philosophical points concerning divine providence, for example, the problem of evil. For the first two volumes of the Summa Contra Gentiles, Aquinas proceeds without substantial appeal to the authority of Scripture (although Aquinas does repeatedly point to the agreement between what he arrived at philosophically and what Christians hold by faith in their Scriptures). He seems to intend his arguments to presuppose as little of the Christian faith as possible. The Summa Contra Gentiles, traditionally, was pointed out as one of the principal locations of Aquinas natural theology. One old interpretation of the Summa Contra Gentiles says that its purpose was to train Christian missionaries who would be required to engage Muslims in discussion and debate about God. Since Christians and Muslims held no common sacred texts, they would need to dispute in terms afforded by their common humanity, that is, the truths of natural reason. Another interpretation makes it out to be Aquinas’s own preparation for his SummaTtheologice (Hibbs, 1995).

Thomas Aquinas’s distinction of the two sorts of truths about God and the two ways of knowing the truth about God soon faced outbreaks of skepticism. That skepticism, ironically, led to several developments in natural theology.

6. Modern Philosophy and Natural Theology

Not long after Aquinas, certain philosophers began to doubt that knowledge of God could be obtained apart from divine revelation and faith. William of Ockham (1280 – 1348) rejected central theses of Aristotelian philosophy that Aquinas relied upon in arguing for the existence of God, divine attributes, divine providence, and so forth. Ockham rejected the Aristotelian theory of form. He believed that a world construed in terms of Aristotelian essences was incompatible with God and creation as revealed in Scripture. To Ockham, Aquinas’s God seemed subject to the natures of things rather than being their author in any significant sense. Nonetheless, Ockham was a Christian. Having rejected the Aristotelian theory of form and essence, natural theology as practiced by Aquinas was not possible. Of the two ways available for obtaining some knowledge of God – faith in revelation and reason without revelation – Ockham rejected the latter. Consequently, the only way remaining to know something of God was by faith in divine revelation.

After Ockham, the modern period abounded in various views towards natural theology. On the one hand, there were many who continued to hold that nature affords some knowledge of God and that human nature has some way of approaching God even apart from revelation. The scholastic thinker Francisco Suarez (1548-1617), for example, presented arguments for the existence of God, divine attributes, and divine providence. On the other hand, the rise of general anti-Aristotelianism (for example, Bacon), the rise of a mechanistic conception of the universe (for example, Hobbes, and the methodological decision to ignore final causality (for example, Descartes), all made traditional theological arguments for the existence of God from nature harder to sustain. Modern philosophy and modern science was perceived by many to threaten the traditional claims and conclusions of natural theology, for example, that the existence and attributes of God can be known apart from revelation and faith.

Many Christian thinkers responded to the new situation posed by modern philosophy and modern science. These responses shared with modern philosophy and modern science a non-Aristotelian, and perhaps even anti-Aristotelian, line of thought. Consequently, these responses constitute a thoroughly non-Aristotelian form of natural theology, that is, a natural theology that does not presuppose any of Aristotle’s views on nature, motion, causality, and so forth.

Descartes himself, for example, is commonly thought to have offered a new version of the ontological argument (Anselm’s argument) for the existence of God. Descartes advanced his argument in such a way that not only did he intend to avoid any Aristotelian presuppositions about the external world, he apparently intended to avoid any presuppositions at all about the external world – even the presupposition of its existence. Descartes’ rationalist and a priori method characterized much of the natural theology on the continent of Europe. In Great Britain, there grew up another form of natural theology tending to use empirical starting points and consciously probabilistic forms of argument. Two examples are noteworthy in this regard. Samuel Clark’s (1675 – 1729) work A Demonstration of the Being and Attributes of God and Joseph Butler’s (1692 – 1752) Analogy of Religion, Natural and Revealed. The former latter work begins from the fact, presumably accessible empirically, that something or other has always existed. It proceeds to argue for the existence of God and various attributes, for example, God’s infinity and omnipresence. The latter work offers a probabilistic argument in favor of the existence of God and certain attributes based on analogies between what is found in nature and what is found in revelation.

David Hume (1711 – 1761) offered perhaps the most poignant criticisms of the post-Aristotelian forms of natural theology. His Enquiry Concerning Human Understanding contained a chapter criticizing the justification for belief in miracles as well as a chapter leveled against arguments from design. The latter criticism against design arguments, as well as additional criticisms of various divine attributes, was offered in much more extensive detail in his Dialogues Concerning Natural Religion. The latter work was more extensive in that it applied some of the central tenets of Hume’s epistemology to natural theology in general, and thus served as a sort of critique of natural theology as a whole. Inspired by Hume’s thought, the empiricist critique of natural theology would later take on even more expanded and sophisticated forms.

David Hume’s agnostic and atheistic conclusions, however, did not find much popular appeal in his own day. Hence, even after Hume’s death, William Paley (1743–1805) was able to advance a natural theology that became standard reading in universities for the first half of the nineteenth century. Paley’s Natural Theology or Evidences of the Existence and Attributes of the Deity formulated a version of the design argument that even convinced the early Charles Darwin. Although Hume did not dissuade his contemporaries such as Paley from doing natural theology, Hume still had a significant impact on natural theology through his influence on Immanuel Kant.

Immanuel Kant (1724 – 1804) found himself faced on the one side with a rationalism that made quite ambitious metaphysical claims and on the other side with an empiricism that allowed humans to know little beyond what was immediately sensible. The rationalists claimed to offer in modo geometrico, a series of demonstrations of many truths about God proceeding from a set of axioms self-evident to reason and needing no empirical verification. Later, their approach would be called a priori. The empiricists followed a different course, and stressed the human incapacity to know substantive necessary truths, or at least Hume seems to have stressed this or Hume as Kant understood him. Kant became skeptical of the rationalist’s metaphysical ambitions, yet was eager to overcome the Humean skepticism that threatened not only metaphysics but the new science as well. In his work, Kant is widely thought to have posed perhaps the most significant argumentative challenge to theology, natural theology, and metaphysics in general.

For Kant, arguments for the existence of God cannot prove their point due to the limits of the human cognitive capacity. The apparent cogency of such arguments is due to transcendental illusion; confusing the constitution of things and the constitution of one’s thought or experience of things. For example, causal principles such as “every event has a cause” are nothing but requirements for the rational organization of our perceptions. Demonstrations of God’s existence, divine attributes, and divine providence, to the extent that they use such principles as premises concerning the constitution of things in themselves, are illusory. Henceforth, any attempt to do classical theology, natural theology, or metaphysics had to answer the Kantian challenge.

Natural theology after Kant took two various routes. In Protestant and Anglican circles, the influence of Paley and others suffered a blow from Charles Darwin’s (1809 – 1882) theory of evolution and the subsequent evolutionary theories that have been developed. Given Darwin, the proposition that all life developed by chance alone is widely perceived to have a degree of plausibility that it was not perceived to have in Paley’s day. Whether and to what extent Darwinian principles eliminate the necessity for positing a divine designer is one of the most hotly contested issues in natural theology today. But there was more to post-Kantian natural theology.

In Catholic circles, natural theology went in two directions. On the one hand, there were some who intended to use modern philosophy for theological purposes just as the mediaevals had done. Antonio Rosmini (1797 – 1855), for example, developed a theology and a natural theology using elements from Augustine, Bonaventure, Pascal, and Malebranche. On the other hand, there were some who revived the thought of Thomas Aquinas. At first, there were but a handful of neo-Thomists. But in time Thomism was not only revived, but disseminated through a vast system of Catholic education. Thomists disagreed amongst each other on how to relate to strands of contemporary thought such as science and Kant. So neo-Thomism grew in many directions: Transcendental Thomism, Aristotelian Thomism, Existential Thomism, and so forth. At any rate, neo-Thomists tended to develop their own counter-reading of modern philosophy – especially Kant – and to use Thomistic natural theology as an apparatus for higher education and apologetics.

7. Natural Theology Today

Outside neo-Thomistic circles, natural theology was generally out of favor throughout the twentieth century. Due to neo-Kantian criticisms of metaphysics, an extreme confidence in contemporary science, a revival and elaboration of Humean empiricism in the form of logical positivism, as well as existentialism among Continental thinkers, metaphysics was thought to be forever eliminated as a way of knowing or understanding truth about God (or anything at all for that matter). Natural theology was thought to have suffered the same fate as being part of metaphysics. It is fair to say that in many places metaphysics and natural theology were even held in contempt. Towards the second half of the twentieth century, however, the tide began to turn – first in favor of the possibility of metaphysics and soon afterwards to a revival of natural theology.

Natural theology today is practiced with a degree of diversity and confidence unprecedented since the late Middle Ages. Natural theologians have revived and extended arguments like Anselm’s (the so-called “perfect being theology”). They have also re-cast arguments from nature in several forms – from neo-Thomistic presentations of Aquinas’s five ways to new teleological arguments drawing upon the results of contemporary cosmology. Arguments from the reality of an objective moral order to the existence of God are circulated and taken seriously. Ethical theories that define goodness in terms of divine command are considered live options among an array of ethical theories. Discussions of divine attributes abound in books and journals devoted exclusively to purely philosophical treatments of God, for example, the journal Faith and Philosophy. Debates rage over divine causality, the extent of God’s providence, and the reality of human free choice. The problem of evil has also been taken up anew for fresh discussions – both by those who see it as arguing against the existence of God and by those who wish to defend theism against the reality of evil. It is English speaking “analytic” philosophers who have taken the lead in discussing and debating these topics.

For people of faith who wish to think through their faith, to see whether reason alone apart from revelation offers anything to corroborate, clarify, or justify what is held by faith, there is no shortage of materials to research or study or criticize. Rather, vast quantities of books, articles, debates, discussions, conferences, and gatherings are available. For those who have no faith, but wish to inquire into God without faith, the same books, articles, debates, discussion, conferences, and gatherings are available. Natural theology is alive and well to assist anyone interested grappling with the perennial questions about God.

8. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

i. Ancient Mediaeval Theology

• Plato, Republic, particularly Bk. VII.
  • The so-called “Allegory of the Cave” in the opening pages of Bk. VII was an influential text upon later conceptions of God and the Good.
• Aristotle, Physics, particularly Bk. VII & VIII.
  • The locus classicus for the argument from motion for the existence of a first, unmoved mover.
• Aristotle, Metaphysics, particularly Bk. XII
  • This passage takes the argument of the Physics Bks. VII & VIII a step further by arguing that the first mover moves things as an end or goal and is intelligent.

ii. Mediaeval Natural Theology

• Augustine, Confessions, trans. Chadwick, Henry. Oxford, 1992.
  • A classic autobiographical account of a thinking man’s journey to faith in the Christian God. In Bk.VI, Augustine draws a distinction between things demonstrable and things to be taken on authority.
• Augustine, On Free Choice of the Will, trans. Williams, Thomas. Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing Company, 1993.
  • Out of the many works of St. Augustine, Bks. II & III in this work come as close as possible to presenting an argument for the existence of God. Augustine considers eternal truths, the order of the world, and the nature of reason, and proceeds to discuss the relationship between these things and the wisdom the pre-existed that world. Many students find this dialogue satisfying to read.
• Boethius, The Consolation of Philosophy. trans. Green, Richard. New York: Macmillan Publishing Company, 1962.
  • A shorter work, cast in semi-dialogue form, that synthesizes and presents a great deal of late Hellenistic natural theology. It is fair to call this work one of the principal sources of mediaeval humanism and philosophy. Many students find this work satisfying to read.
• Plotinus, Enneads. trans. MacKenna, Stephen. New York: Larson Publications, 1992.
  • A lengthy work of neo-Platonic cosmology and natural theology. Being the work of a non-Christian, it shows (like Aristotle’s works) that someone without Christian faith commitments can engage in natural theology. However, Plotinus’ sympathies lie more with Plato’s notion of a dialectically induced vision of the Good than with a demonstrative approach to proving the existence of God. Consequently, there are many passages of a more mystical and meditative quality intended for those who have had the prerequisite perceptions of the One.
• Pseudo-Dionysius, “Letter Nine” in The Complete Works. trans. Luibheid, Colm. New Jersey: Paulist Press, 1987.
  • Presents the distinction between natural and mystical theology and the two ways of knowing that are proper to each.
• Anselm, “Monologion” & “Proslogion” both in The Major Works. Oxford University Press, 1998.
  • The Proslogion contains the so-called “ontological argument” for the existence of God. The Monologion, in its first two dozen chapters, presents a natural theology by way of unpacking what is involved in the notion of a supreme nature.
• Aquinas, SummaTtheologiae, trans. Fathers of the English Dominican Province. New York: Benziger Bros, 1948 .
  • The classic theological work by Thomas Aquinas. In part I, q. 2 – 27, Aquinas presents numerous philosophical arguments for the existence of God, divine attributes, divine providence, and so forth. Often called the “Treatise on God,” it is a classic locus of natural theology.
• Aquinas, Summa Contra Gentiles, esp. trans. Pegis, Anton. University of Notre Dame Press, 1975.
  • In Bks. I & II, Aquinas presents what he considers to be demonstrations for the existence of God, several divine attributes, and an account of divine providence. For these two books, a great deal of the thinking is commonly thought to proceed in the light of natural reason alone.
• Bonaventure, The Journey of the Mind to God. trans. Boehner, Philotheus. Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing Company, 1993.
  • A short work of mediaeval natural theology. A contemporary of Aquinas, Bonaventure takes the reader on a journey from creatures to the Creator. This book shows what an alternative to Aquinas’s Aristotelian natural theology looks like.

iii. Modern Natural Theology

• Butler, Joseph. The Analogy of Religion, Natural and Revealed, to the Constitution and Course of Nature. Ann Arbor, MI: Scholarly Publishing Office, University of Michigan Library, 2005.
  • A classic of English natural theology with an extended treatment of the immortality of the soul. The author ventures a probabilistic argument in confirmation of certain revealed truths.
• Clark, Samuel. A Demonstration of the Being and Attributes of God: And Other Writings. Ed. Vailato, Ezio. Cambridge University Press, 1998.
  • This treatise of English natural theology was originally a set of sermons preached against the writings of Hobbes and Spinoza and their followers. Those sermons were revised into an extended and rigorous argument.
• Descartes, Rene. “Meditations” in Selected Philosophical Writings. trans. Cottingham, John., Stoothoff, Robert., Murdoch, Dougald. Cambridge University Press, 1998.
  • In the “Third Meditation,” Descartes advances an argument for the existence of God that some have called an “ontological argument” because he infers from his idea of God to the existence of God.
• Locke, John. An Essay Concerning Human Understanding. Oxford University Press, 1975.
  • In Bk. IV, ch. 10 John Locke advances what he considers to be a demonstration of the existence of an eternal and necessary being. The chapter is an example of how arguments for the existence of God continued to be advanced well into early modernity by post-Aristotelian thinkers.
• Hume, David. An Enquiry Concerning Human Understanding. Indianapolis, IN: Hackett Publishing Company, 1977.
  • A brief classical essay in empiricist philosophy. The principles presented in this book served first to motivate Kant to mount his criticisms of metaphysics and natural theology and continue to motivate many of today’s criticisms of arguments for the existence of God, divine attributes, and so forth.
• Hume, David. Dialogues Concerning Natural Religion: The Posthumous Essays of the Immortality of the Soul and of Suicide. Indianapolis, IN: Hackett Publishing Co., 1998.
  • This dialogue is an extended application of Hume’s epistemology, and in effect a critique of natural theology as an enterprise.
• Kant, Immanuel. Critique of Pure Reason. trans. Smith, Norman Kemp. NY: St. Martin’s Press. 1929.
  • This classical work stands as a permanent challenge to anyone aiming at arriving at some knowledge or understanding of God by the light of natural reason alone. The work is no easy read – not even for specialists. However, in Part II, Second Division, Chapter II, Kant presents his famous “antinomies of pure reason.” The antinomies are arguments, laid out in synopsis form, both for and against certain theses. Of all the criticism of metaphysics that can be found in this book, the antinomies in particular have persuaded many thinkers to hold that any attempt by reason alone to arrive at some knowledge of God is bound to end in hopeless self-contradiction. See especially the Fourth Antinomy.
• Kant, Immanuel. Prolegomena to Any Future Metaphysics. trans. Ellington, James W. Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing Company, 1977.
  • This shorter work summarizes and presents in simpler form much of the thought found in the longer and more elaborate Critique of Pure Reason.
• Newman, John Henry Cardinal. An Essay in Aid of a Grammar of Assent. University of Notre Dame Press, 1979.
  • A classic work of nineteenth century British apologetics. Among many other things, Newman presents an account of how conscience moves one to believe in the existence of God.

iv. Contemporary Natural Theology

• Howard-Snyder, Daniel, ed. The Evidential Argument from Evil. Indiana University Press, 1996.
  • An excellent anthology of essays, all treating of the problem of evil, by contemporary philosophers. The collection contains some essays arguing against the existence of God on the basis of evil and other essays defending the existence of God against such arguments.
• Kenny, Anthony. The Five Ways: St. Thomas Aquinas’ proofs of the existence of God. London: Routledge & K. Paul, 1969.
  • A short work that goes through Aquinas’s arguments for the existence of God and treats them in terms of contemporary formal logic. Kenny concludes that all the arguments fail.
• Mackie, J.L., The Miracle of Theism: Arguments for and against the existence of God. Oxford University Press, 1982.
  • A widely read work that presents a wide variety of arguments for the existence of God, criticizes them, and ultimately rejects them all. It also contains important discussions of who has the burden of proof in natural theology and arguments against the existence of God based on the reality of evil.
• Plantinga, Alvin. God and Other Minds. Cornell University Press, 1967.
  • Another work that presents several standard proofs for the existence of God and criticizes them. The author, however, is a theist. After dismissing the standard proofs for the existence of God as inconclusive or indecisive, Plantinga goes on to give an argument that belief in the existence of God can be rational even without such proofs. He argues that believing in God is analogous to believing in other minds. Just as one is rational in believing in other minds without decisive or conclusive proof that other minds exist, so one is rational in believing in God without decisive or conclusive proof that God exists.
• Plantinga, Alvin. God, Freedom, & Evil. William B. Eerdmans Publishing Co., 1977.
  • This widely hailed work purports to refute the thesis that it is impossible for both God and evil to exist. Using the modal logic that he helped to pioneer, Plantinga shows how it is possible for both God and evil to exist. Even atheist philosophers find Plantinga’s point to be compelling, and the terms of the debate on the problem of evil have changed since, and because of, the book’s publication. For the current state of the debate, see Howard-Snyder’s work referenced above.
• Swinburne, Richard. The Coherence of Theism. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1977.
   Swinburne, Richard. The Existence of God. 2nd Edition. Oxford University Press, 2004.
  Swinburne, Richard. Providence and the Problem of Evil. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1998.
  • These three books by Richard Swinburne jointly constitute a powerful argument for, and defense of, the existence of God. In The Coherence of Theism, Swinburne answers common arguments advanced against the possibility of the existence of God or arguing for the existence of God. In The Existence of God, Swinburne presents his “cumulative case” inductive argument for the existence of God. In Providence and the Problem of Evil, Swinburne aims to account for the existence of evil given the existence of a provident God.
• Varghese, Roy Abraham. The Wonder of the World: A Journey from Modern Science to the Mind of God. Arizona: Tyr Publishing, 2004.
  • This work brings together under one cover many of the scientifically received facts that tend to confirm the existence of God. One can find laid out here many of the physical, biological, and cosmological facts that have persuaded many contemporary scientists of the existence of an intelligent God behind it all. The work also raises pertinent philosophical considerations in favor of the same conclusion. Written in semi-dialogue form, without using significant technical jargon, this award-winning book is accessible to a wide audience.

b. Secondary Sources

• Craig, William Lane. The Cosmological Argument from Plato to Leibniz. NY: Barnes & Noble Books, 1980.
  • The book does what the title says; it gives a history of the various cosmological arguments from ancient times until modernity.
• Congar, Yves. A History of Theology. NY: Doubleday, 1968.
  • A good one-volume summary of the history of theology. This book served as the basic reference for section 3 above in the discussion of ancient Greek theology, and the development of theology among early Christians.
• Davies, Brian. An Introduction to the Philosophy of Religion. Oxford University Press, 1982.
  • This widely used textbook presents most of the main topics in the philosophy of religion today – including arguments in natural theology.
• Hibbs, Thomas. Dialectic and Narrative in Aquinas: An Interpretation of the Summa Contra Gentiles. University of Notre Dame Press, 1995.
  • This book was referenced above as presenting an alternative interpretation to the Summa Contra Gentiles.
• LeClerq, Jean. The Love of Learning and the Desire for God. trans. Misrah, Catharine. Fordham University Press, 1982.
  • This book was referenced in the fourth section above as regards the state of theology in mediaeval monasteries.
• Stump, Eleonore. “Aquinas on the Sufferings of Job” in The Evidential Argument from Evil. ed. Howard-Snyder, Daniel. Indiana University Press, 1996.
  • An unusually clear elucidation of Aquinas’ understanding of the relationship between God and evil as Aquinas presents it in his commentary on Job.
• Stump, Eleonore, ed. Philosophy of Religion. Malden, MA: Blackwell Publishers, 1999.
  • An anthology of classic texts on many topics in the philosophy of religion. Many of the texts referenced in this list are found within this anthology.

Author Information

James Brent
Email: jbrentop@gmail.com
Saint Louis University
U. S. A.