Deductive and Inductive Arguments

In philosophy, an argument consists of a set of statements called premises that serve as grounds for affirming another statement called the conclusion. Philosophers typically distinguish arguments in natural languages (such as English) into two fundamentally different types: deductive and inductive. Each type of argument is said to have characteristics that categorically distinguish it from the other type. The two types of argument are also said to be subject to differing evaluative standards. Pointing to paradigmatic examples of each type of argument helps to clarify their key differences. The distinction between the two types of argument may hardly seem worthy of philosophical reflection, as evidenced by the fact that their differences are usually presented as straightforward, such as in many introductory philosophy textbooks. Nonetheless, the question of how best to distinguish deductive from inductive arguments, and indeed whether there is a coherent categorical distinction between them at all, turns out to be considerably more problematic than commonly recognized. This article identifies and discusses a range of different proposals for marking categorical differences between deductive and inductive arguments while highlighting the problems and limitations attending each. Consideration is also given to the ways in which one might do without a distinction between two types of argument by focusing instead solely on the application of evaluative standards to arguments.

Introduction
Psychological Approaches
Behavioral Approaches
Arguments that “Purport”
Evidential Completeness
Logical Necessity vs. Probability
The Question of Validity
Formalization and Logical Rules to the Rescue?
Other Even Less Promising Proposals
An Evaluative Approach
References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

In philosophy, an argument consists of a set of statements called premises that serve as grounds for affirming another statement called the conclusion. Philosophers typically distinguish arguments in natural languages (such as English) into two fundamentally different kinds: deductive and inductive. (Matters become more complicated when considering arguments in formal systems of logic as well as in the many forms of non-classical logic. Readers are invited to consult the articles on Logic in this encyclopedia to explore some of these more advanced topics.) In the philosophical literature, each type of argument is said to have characteristics that categorically distinguish it from the other type.

Deductive arguments are sometimes illustrated by providing an example in which an argument’s premises logically entail its conclusion. For example:

Socrates is a man.
All men are mortal.
Therefore, Socrates is mortal.

Assuming the truth of the two premises, it seems that it simply must be the case that Socrates is mortal. According to this view, then, this would be a deductive argument.

By contrast, inductive arguments are said to be those that make their conclusions merely probable. They might be illustrated by an example like the following:

Most Greeks eat olives.
Socrates is a Greek.
Therefore, Socrates eats olives.

Assuming the truth of those premises, it is likely that Socrates eats olives, but that is not guaranteed. According to this view, this argument is inductive.

This way of viewing arguments has a long history in philosophy. An explicit distinction between two fundamentally distinct argument types goes back to Aristotle (384-322 B.C.E.) who, in his works on logic (later dubbed “The Organon”, meaning “the instrument”) distinguished syllogistic reasoning (sullogismos) from “reasoning from particulars to universals” (epagôgê). Centuries later, induction was famously advertised by Francis Bacon (1561-1626) in his New Organon (1620) as the royal road to knowledge, while Rationalist mathematician-philosophers, such as René Descartes (1596-1650) in his Discourse on the Method (1637), favored deductive methods of inquiry. Albert Einstein (1879-1955) discussed the distinction in the context of science in his essay, “Induction and Deduction in Physics” (1919). Much contemporary professional philosophy, especially in the Analytic tradition, focuses on presenting and critiquing deductive and inductive arguments while considering objections and responses to them. It is therefore safe to say that a distinction between deductive and inductive arguments is fundamental to argument analysis in philosophy.

Although a distinction between deductive and inductive arguments is deeply woven into philosophy, and indeed into everyday life, many people probably first encounter an explicit distinction between these two kinds of argument in a pedagogical context. For example, students taking an elementary logic, critical thinking, or introductory philosophy course might be introduced to the distinction between each type of argument and be taught that each have their own standards of evaluation. Deductive arguments may be said to be valid or invalid, and sound or unsound. A valid deductive argument is one whose logical structure or form is such that if the premises are true, the conclusion must be true. A sound argument is a valid argument with true premises. Inductive arguments, by contrast, are said to be strong or weak, and, although terminology varies, they may also be considered cogent or not cogent. A strong inductive argument is said to be one whose premises render the conclusion likely. A cogent argument is a strong argument with true premises. All arguments are made better by having true premises, of course, but the differences between deductive and inductive arguments concern structure, independent of whether the premises of an argument are true, which concerns semantics.

The distinction between deductive and inductive arguments is considered important because, among other things, it is crucial during argument analysis to apply the right evaluative standards to any argument one is considering. Indeed, it is not uncommon to be told that in order to assess any argument, three steps are necessary. First, one is to determine whether the argument being considered is a deductive argument or an inductive one. Second, one is to then determine whether the argument is valid or invalid. Finally, one is to determine whether the argument is sound or unsound (Teays 1996).

All of this would seem to be amongst the least controversial topics in philosophy. Controversies abound in metaphysics, epistemology, and ethics (such as those exhibited in the contexts of Ancient and Environmental Ethics, just to name a couple). By contrast, the basic distinctions between deductive and inductive arguments seem more solid, more secure; in short, more settled than those other topics. Accordingly, one might expect an encyclopedic article on deductive and inductive arguments to simply report the consensus view and to clearly explain and illustrate the distinction for readers not already familiar with it. However, the situation is made more difficult by three facts.

First, there appear to be other forms of argument that do not fit neatly into the classification of deductive or inductive arguments. Govier (1987) calls the view that there are only two kinds of argument (that is, deductive and inductive) “the positivist theory of argument”. She believes that it naturally fits into, and finds justification within, a positivist epistemology, according to which knowledge must be either a priori (stemming from logic or mathematics, deploying deductive arguments) or a posteriori (stemming from the empirical sciences, using inductive arguments). She points out that arguments as most people actually encounter them assume such a wide variety of forms that the “positivist theory of argument” fails to account for a great many of them.

Second, it can be difficult to distinguish arguments in ordinary, everyday discourse as clearly either deductive or inductive. The supposedly sharp distinction tends to blur in many cases, calling into question whether the binary nature of the deductive-inductive distinction is correct.

Third (this point being the main focus of this article), a perusal of elementary logic and critical thinking texts, as well as other presentations aimed at non-specialist readers, demonstrates that there is in fact no consensus about how to draw the supposedly straightforward deductive-inductive argument distinction, as least within the context of introducing the distinction to newcomers. Indeed, proposals vary from locating the distinction within subjective, psychological states of arguers to objective features of the arguments themselves, with other proposals landing somewhere in-between.

Remarkably, not only do proposals vary greatly, but the fact that they do so at all, and that they generate different and indeed incompatible conceptions of the deductive-inductive argument distinction, also seems to go largely unremarked upon by those advancing such proposals. Many authors confidently explain the distinction between deductive and inductive arguments without the slightest indication that there are other apparently incompatible ways of making such a distinction. Moreover, there appears to be little scholarly discussion concerning whether the alleged distinction even makes sense in the first place. That there is a coherent, unproblematic distinction between deductive and inductive arguments, and that the distinction neatly assigns arguments to one or the other of the two non-overlapping kinds, is an assumption that usually goes unnoticed and unchallenged. Even a text with the title Philosophy of Logics (Haack 1978) makes no mention of this fundamental philosophical problem.

A notable exception has already been mentioned in Govier (1987), who explicitly critiques what she calls “the hallowed old distinction between inductive and deductive arguments.” However, her insightful discussion turns out to be the exception that proves the rule. Her critique appears not to have awoken philosophers from their dogmatic slumbers concerning the aforementioned issues of the deductive-inductive argument classification. Moreover, her discussion, while perceptive, does not engage the issue with the level of sustained attention that it deserves, presumably because her primary concerns lay elsewhere. In short, the problem of distinguishing between deductive and inductive arguments seems not to have registered strongly amongst philosophers. A consequence is that the distinction is often presented as if it were entirely unproblematic. Whereas any number of other issues are subjected to penetrating philosophical analysis, this fundamental issue typically traipses past unnoticed.

Accordingly, this article surveys, discusses, and assesses a range of common (and other not-so-common) proposals for distinguishing between deductive and inductive arguments, ranging from psychological approaches that locate the distinction within the subjective mental states of arguers, to approaches that locate the distinction within objective features of arguments themselves. It aims first to provide a sense of the remarkable diversity of views on this topic, and hence of the significant, albeit typically unrecognized, disagreements concerning this issue. Along the way, it is pointed out that none of the proposed distinctions populating the relevant literature are entirely without problems. This is especially the case when related to other philosophical views which many philosophers would be inclined to accept, although some of the problems that many of the proposed distinctions face may be judged to be more serious than others.

In light of these difficulties, a fundamentally different approach is then sketched: rather than treating a categorical deductive-inductive argument distinction as entirely unproblematic (as a great many authors do), these problems are made explicit so that emphasis can be placed on the need to develop evaluative procedures for assessing arguments without identifying them as strictly “deductive” or “inductive.” This evaluative approach to argument analysis respects the fundamental rationale for distinguishing deductive from inductive arguments in the first place, namely as a tool for helping one to decide whether the conclusion of any argument deserves assent. Such an approach bypasses the problems associated with categorical approaches that attempt to draw a sharp distinction between deductive and inductive arguments. Ultimately, the deductive-inductive argument distinction should be dispensed with entirely, a move which is no doubt a counterintuitive conclusion for some that nonetheless can be made plausible by attending to the arguments that follow.

First, a word on strategy. Each of the proposals considered below will be presented from the outset in its most plausible form in order to see why it might seem attractive, at least initially so. The consequences of accepting each proposal are then delineated, consequences that might well give one pause in thinking that the deductive-inductive argument distinction in question is satisfactory.

2. Psychological Approaches

Perhaps the most popular approach to distinguish between deductive and inductive arguments is to take a subjective psychological state of the agent advancing a given argument to be the crucial factor. For example, one might be informed that whereas a deductive argument is intended to provide logically conclusive support for its conclusion, an inductive argument is intended to provide only probable, but not conclusive, support (Barry 1992; Vaughn 2010; Harrell 2016; and many others). Some accounts of this sort could hardly be more explicit that such psychological factors alone are the key factor. From this perspective, then, it may be said that the difference between deductive and inductive arguments does not lie in the words used within the arguments, but rather in the intentions of the arguer. That is to say, the difference between each type of argument comes from the relationship the arguer takes there to be between the premises and the conclusion. If the arguer believes that the truth of the premises definitely establishes the truth of the conclusion, then the argument is deductive. If the arguer believes that the truth of the premises provides only good reasons to believe the conclusion is probably true, then the argument is inductive. According to this psychological account, the distinction between deductive and inductive arguments is determined exclusively by the intentions and/or beliefs of the person advancing an argument.

This psychological approach entails some interesting, albeit often unacknowledged, consequences. Because the difference between deductive and inductive arguments is said to be determined entirely by what an arguer intends or believes about any given argument, it follows that what is ostensibly the very same argument may be equally both deductive and inductive.

An example may help to illustrate this point. If person A believes that the premise in the argument “Dom Pérignon is a champagne; so, it is made in France” definitely establishes its conclusion (perhaps on the grounds that “champagne” is a type of sparkling wine produced only in the Champagne wine region of France), then according to the psychological approach being considered, this would be a deductive argument. However, if person B believes that the premise of the foregoing argument provides only good reasons to believe that the conclusion is true (perhaps because they think of “champagne” as merely any sort of fizzy wine), then the argument in question is also an inductive argument. Therefore, it is entirely possible on this psychological view for the same argument to be both a deductive and an inductive argument. It is a deductive argument because of what person A believes. It is also an inductive argument because of what person B believes. Indeed, this consequence need not involve different individuals at all. This result follows even if the same individual maintains different beliefs and/or intentions with respect to the argument’s strength at different times.

The belief-relativity inherent in this psychological approach is not by itself an objection, much less a decisive one. Olson (1975) explicitly advances such an account, and frankly embraces its intention- or belief-relative consequences. Perhaps the fundamental nature of arguments is relative to individuals’ intentions or beliefs, and thus the same argument can be both deductive and inductive. However, this psychological approach does place logical constraints on what else one can coherently claim. For example, one cannot coherently maintain that, given the way the terms ‘deductive argument’ and ‘inductive argument’ are categorized here, an argument is always one or the other and never both. If this psychological account of the deductive-inductive argument distinction is accepted, then the latter claim is necessarily false.

Of course, there is a way to reconcile the psychological approach considered here with the claim that an argument is either deductive or inductive, but never both. One could opt to individuate arguments on the basis of individuals’ specific intentions or beliefs about them. In this more sophisticated approach, what counts as a specific argument would depend on the intentions or beliefs regarding it. So, for example, if person A believes that “Dom Pérignon is a champagne; so, it is made in France” definitely establishes the truth of its conclusion, while person B believes that “Dom Pérignon is a champagne; so, it is made in France” provides only good reasons for thinking that its conclusion is true, then there isn’t just one argument here after all. Rather, according to this more sophisticated account, there are two distinct arguments here that just happen to be formulated using precisely the same words. According to this view, the belief that there is just one argument here would be naïve. Hence, it could still be the case that any argument is deductive or inductive, but never both. Arguments just need to be multiplied as needed.

However, this more sophisticated strategy engenders some interesting consequences of its own. Since intentions and beliefs can vary in clarity, intensity, and certainty, any ostensible singular argument may turn out to represent as many distinct arguments as there are persons considering a given inference. So, for example, what might initially have seemed like a single argument (say, St. Anselm of Canterbury‘s famous ontological argument for the existence of God) might turn out in this view to be any number of different arguments because different thinkers may harbor different degrees of intention or belief about how well the argument’s premises support its conclusion.

On a similar note, the same ostensible single argument may turn out to be any number of arguments if the same individual entertains different intentions or beliefs (or different degrees of intention or belief) at different times concerning how well its premises support its conclusion, as when one reflects upon an argument for some time. Again, this is not necessarily an objection to this psychological approach, much less a decisive one. A proponent of this psychological approach could simply bite the bullet and concede that what at first appeared to be a single argument may in fact be many.

Be that as it may, there are yet other logical consequences of adopting such a psychological account of the deductive-inductive argument distinction that, taken together with the foregoing considerations, may raise doubts about whether such an account could be the best way to capture the relevant distinction. Because intentions and beliefs are not publicly accessible, and indeed may not always be perfectly transparent even to oneself, confident differentiation of deductive and inductive arguments may be hard or even impossible in many, or even in all, cases. For example, in cases where one does not or cannot know what the arguer’s intentions or beliefs are (or were), it is necessarily impossible to identify which type of argument it is, assuming, again, that it must be either one type or the other. If the first step in evaluating an argument is determining which type of argument it is, one cannot even begin.

In response, it might be advised to look for the use of indicator words or phrases as clues to discerning an arguer’s intentions or beliefs. The use of words like “necessarily,” or “it follows that,” or “therefore it must be the case that” could be taken to indicate that the arguer intends the argument to definitely establish its conclusion, and therefore, according to the psychological proposal being considered, one might judge it to be a deductive argument. Alternatively, the use of words like “probably,” “it is reasonable to conclude,” or “it is likely” could be interpreted to indicate that the arguer intends only to make the argument’s conclusion probable. One might judge it to be an inductive argument on that basis.

However, while indicator words or phrases may suggest specific interpretations, they need to be viewed in context, and are far from infallible guides. At best, they are indirect clues as to what any arguer might believe or intend. Someone may say one thing, but intend or believe something else. This need not involve intentional lying. Intentions and beliefs are often opaque, even to the person whose intentions and beliefs they are. Moreover, they are of limited help in providing an unambiguous solution in many cases. Consider the following example:

Most Major League Baseball outfielders consistently have batting averages over .250. Since Ken Singleton played centerfield for the Orioles for three consecutive years, he must have been batting over .250 when he was traded.

If one takes seriously the “must have” clause in the last sentence, it might be concluded that the proponent of this argument intended to provide a deductive argument and thus, according to the psychological approach, it is a deductive argument. If one is not willing to ascribe that intention to the argument’s author, it might be concluded that he meant to advance an inductive argument. In some cases, it simply cannot be known. To offer another example, consider this argument:

It has rained every day so far this month.
If it has rained every day so far this month, then probably it will rain today.
Therefore, probably it will rain today.

The word “probably” appears twice, suggesting that this may be an inductive argument. Yet, many would agree that the argument’s conclusion is “definitely established” by its premises. Consequently, while being on the lookout for the appearance of certain indicator words is a commendable policy for dealing fairly with the arguments one encounters, it does not provide a perfectly reliable criterion for categorically distinguishing deductive and inductive arguments.

This consequence might be viewed as merely an inconvenient limitation on human knowledge, lamentably another instance of which there already are a great many. However, there is a deeper worry associated with a psychological approach than has been considered thus far. Recall that a common psychological approach distinguishes deductive and inductive arguments in terms of the intentions or beliefs of the arguer with respect to any given argument being considered. If the arguer intends or believes the argument to be one that definitely establishes its conclusion, then it is a deductive argument. If the arguer intends or believes the argument to be one that merely makes its conclusion probable, then it is an inductive argument. But what if the person putting forth the argument intends or believes neither of those things?

Philosophy instructors routinely share arguments with their students without any firm beliefs regarding whether they definitely establish their conclusions or whether they instead merely make their conclusions probable. Likewise, they may not have any intentions with respect to the arguments in question other than merely the intention to share them with their students. For example, if an argument is put forth merely as an illustration, or rhetorically to show how someone might argue for an interesting thesis, with the person sharing the argument not embracing any intentions or beliefs about what it does show, then on the psychological approach, the argument is neither a deductive nor an inductive argument. This runs counter to the view that every argument must be one or the other.

Nor can it be said that such an argument must be deductive or inductive for someone else, due to the fact that there is no guarantee that anyone has any beliefs or intentions regarding the argument. In this case, then, if the set of sentences in question still qualifies as an argument, what sort of argument is it? It would seem to exist in a kind of logical limbo or no man’s land. It would be neither deductive nor inductive. Furthermore, there is no reason to suppose that it is some other type, unless it isn’t really an argument at all, since no one intends or believes anything about how well it establishes its conclusion. In that case, one is faced with the peculiar situation in which someone believes that a set of sentences is an argument, and yet it cannot be an argument because, according to the psychological view, no one has any intentions for the argument to establish its conclusion, nor any beliefs about how well it does so. However, it could still become a deductive or inductive argument should someone come to embrace it with greater, or with lesser, conviction, respectively. With this view, arguments could continually flicker into and out of existence.

These considerations do not show that a purely psychological criterion for distinguishing deductive and inductive arguments must be wrong, as that would require adopting some other presumably more correct standard for making the deductive-inductive argument distinction, which would then beg the question against any psychological approach. Logically speaking, nothing prevents one from accepting all the foregoing consequences, no matter how strange and inelegant they may be. However, there are other troubling consequences of adopting a psychological approach to consider.

Suppose that it is said that an argument is deductive if the person advancing it believes that it definitely establishes its conclusion. According to this account, if the person advancing an argument believes that it definitely establishes its conclusion, then it is definitively deductive. If, however, everyone else who considers the argument thinks that it makes its conclusion merely probable at best, then the person advancing the argument is completely right and everyone else is necessarily wrong.

For example, consider the following argument: “It has rained nearly every day so far this month. So, it will for sure rain tomorrow as well.” If the person advancing this argument believes that the premise definitely establishes its conclusion, then according to such a psychological view, it is necessarily a deductive argument, despite the fact that it would appear to most others to at best make its conclusion merely probable. Or, to take an even more striking example, consider Dr. Samuel Johnson’s famous attempted refutation of Bishop George Berkeley‘s immaterialism (roughly, the view that there are no material things, but only ideas and minds) by forcefully kicking a stone and proclaiming “I refute it thus!” If Dr. Johnson sincerely believed that by his action he had logically refuted Berkeley’s immaterialism, then his stone-kicking declaration would be a deductive argument.

Likewise, some arguments that look like an example of a deductive argument will have to be re-classified on this view as inductive arguments if the authors of such arguments believe that the premises provide merely good reasons to accept the conclusions as true. For example, someone might give the following argument:

All men are mortal.
Socrates is a man.
Therefore, Socrates is mortal.

This is the classic example of a deductive argument included in many logic texts. However, if someone advancing this argument believes that the conclusion is merely probable given the premises, then it would, according to this psychological proposal, necessarily be an inductive argument, and not just merely be believed to be so, given that it meets a sufficient condition for being inductive.

A variation on this psychological approach focuses not on intentions and beliefs, but rather on doubts. According to this alternative view, a deductive argument is one such that, if one accepts the truth of the premises, one cannot doubt the truth of the conclusion. By contrast, an inductive argument is one such that, if one accepts the truth of the premises, one can doubt the truth of the conclusion. This view is sometimes expressed by saying that deductive arguments establish their conclusions “beyond a reasonable doubt” (Teays 1996). Deductive arguments, in this view, may be said to be psychologically compelling in a way that inductive arguments are not. Good deductive arguments compel assent, but even quite good inductive arguments do not.

However, a moment’s reflection demonstrates that this approach entails many of the same awkward consequences as do the other psychological criteria previously discussed. What people are capable of doubting is as variable as what they might intend or believe, making this doubt-centered view subject to the same sorts of agent-relative implications facing any intention-or-belief approach.

One might try to circumvent these difficulties by saying that a deductive argument should be understood as one that establishes its conclusion beyond a reasonable doubt. In other words, given the truth of the premises, one should not doubt the truth of the conclusion. Likewise, one might say that an inductive argument is one such that, given the truth of the premises, one should be permitted to doubt the truth of the conclusion. However, this tactic would be to change the subject from the question of what categorically distinguishes deductive and inductive arguments to that of the grounds for deciding whether an argument is a good one – a worthwhile question to ask, to be sure, but a different question than the one being considered here.

Again, in the absence of some independently established distinction between deductive and inductive arguments, these consequences alone cannot refute any psychological account. Collectively, however, they raise questions about whether this way of distinguishing deductive and inductive arguments should be accepted, given that such consequences are hard to reconcile with other common beliefs about arguments, say, about how individuals can be mistaken about what sort of argument they are advancing. Luckily, there are other approaches. However, upon closer analysis these other approaches fare no better than the various psychological approaches thus far considered.

3. Behavioral Approaches

Psychological approaches are, broadly speaking, cognitive. They concern individuals’ mental states, specifically their intentions, beliefs, and/or doubts. Given the necessarily private character of mental states (assuming that brain scans, so far at least, provide only indirect evidence of individuals’ mental states), it may be impossible to know what an individual’s intentions or beliefs really are, or what they are or are not capable of doubting. Hence, it may be impossible given any one psychological approach to know whether any given argument one is considering is a deductive or an inductive one. That and other consequences of that approach seem less than ideal. Can such consequences be avoided?

The problem of knowing others’ minds is not new. A movement in psychology that flourished in the mid-20^th century, some of whose tenets are still evident within 21^st century psychological science, was intended to circumvent problems associated with the essentially private nature of mental states in order to put psychology on a properly scientific footing. According to Behaviorism, one can set aside speculations about individuals’ inaccessible mental states to focus instead on individuals’ publicly observable behaviors. According to certain behaviorists, any purported psychological state can be re-described as a set of behaviors. For example, a belief such as “It will rain today” might be cashed out along the lines of an individual’s behavior of putting on wet-weather gear or carrying an umbrella, behaviors that are empirically accessible insofar as they are available for objective observation. In this way, it was hoped, one can bypass unknowable mental states entirely.

Setting aside the question of whether Behaviorism is viable as a general approach to the mind, a focus on behavior rather than on subjective psychological states in order to distinguish deductive and inductive arguments promises to circumvent the epistemic problems facing a cognitive approach. According to one such proposal, a deductive argument is one whose premises are claimed to support the conclusion such that it would be impossible for the premises to be true and for the conclusion to be false. An inductive argument is one whose premises are claimed to provide only some less-than-conclusive grounds for accepting the conclusion (Copi 1978; Hurley and Watson 2018). A variation on this approach says that deductive arguments are ones in which the conclusion is presented as following from the premises with necessity, whereas inductive arguments are ones in which the conclusion is presented as following from the premises only with some probability (Engel 1994). Notice that, unlike intending or believing, “claiming” and “presenting” are expressible as observable behaviors.

This behavioral approach thus promises to circumvent the epistemic problems facing psychological approaches. What someone explicitly claims an argument shows can usually, or at least often, be determined rather unproblematically. For example, if someone declares “The following argument is a deductive argument, that is, an argument whose premises definitely establish its conclusion,” then, according to the behavioral approach being considered here, it would be a sufficient condition to judge the argument in question to be a deductive argument. Likewise, if someone insists “The following argument is an inductive argument, that is, an argument such that if its premises are true, the conclusion is, at best, probably true as well,” this would be a sufficient condition to conclude that such an argument is inductive. Consequently, some of the problems associated with psychological proposals fall by the wayside. Initially, therefore, this approach looks promising.

The most obvious problem with this approach is that few arguments come equipped with a statement explicitly declaring what sort of argument it is thought to be. As Govier (1987) sardonically notes, “Few arguers are so considerate as to give us a clear indication as to whether they are claiming absolute conclusiveness in the technical sense in which logicians understand it.” This leaves plenty of room for interpretation and speculation concerning the vast majority of arguments, thereby negating the chief hoped for advantage of focusing on behaviors rather than on psychological states.

Alas, other problems loom as well. Having already considered some of the troubling agent-relative consequences of adopting a purely psychological account, it will be easy to anticipate that behavioral approaches, while avoiding some of the psychological approach’s epistemic problems, nonetheless will inherit many of the latter’s agent-relativistic problems in virtually identical form.

First, what is ostensibly the very same argument (that is, consisting of the same sequence of words) in this view may be both a deductive and an inductive argument when advanced by individuals making different claims about what the argument purports to show, regardless of how unreasonable those claims appear to be on other grounds. For example, the following argument (a paradigmatic instance of the modus ponens argument form) would be a deductive argument if person A claims that, or otherwise behaves as if, the premises definitely establish the conclusion:

If P, then Q.
P.
Therefore, Q.

(The capital letters exhibited in this argument are to be understood as variables that can be replaced with declarative sentences, statements, or propositions, namely, items that are true or false. The investigation of logical forms that involve whole sentences is called Propositional Logic.)

However, by the same token, the foregoing argument equally would be an inductive argument if person B claims (even insincerely so, since psychological factors are by definition irrelevant under this view) that its premises provide only less than conclusive support for its conclusion.

Likewise, the following argument would be an inductive argument if person A claims that its premise provides less than conclusive support for its conclusion:

A random sample of voters in Los Angeles County supports a new leash law for pet turtles; so, the law will probably pass by a very wide margin.

However, it would also be a deductive argument if person B claims that its premises definitely establish the truth of its conclusion. On a behavioral approach, then, recall that whether an argument is deductive or inductive is entirely relative to individuals’ claims about it, or to some other behavior. Indeed, this need not involve different individuals at all. An argument would be both a deductive and an inductive argument if the same individual makes contrary claims about it, say, at different times.

If one finds these consequences irksome, one could opt to individuate arguments on the basis of claims about them. So, two individuals might each claim that “Dom Pérignon is a champagne; so, it is made in France.” But if person A claims that the premise of this argument definitely establishes its conclusion, whereas person B claims that the premise merely makes its conclusion probable, there isn’t just one argument about Dom Pérignon being considered, but two: one deductive, the other inductive, each one corresponding to one of the two different claims. There is no need to rehearse the by-now familiar worries concerning these issues, given that these issues are nearly identical to the various ones discussed with regard to the aforementioned psychological approaches.

A proponent of any sort of behavioral approach might bite the bullet and accept all of the foregoing consequences. Since no alternative unproblematic account of the deduction-induction distinction has been presented thus far, such consequences cannot show that a behavioral approach is simply wrong. Likewise, the relativism inherent in this approach is not by itself an objection. Perhaps the distinction between deductive and inductive arguments is relative to the claims made about them. However, this approach is incompatible with the common belief that an argument is either deductive or inductive, but never both. This latter belief would have to be jettisoned if a behavioral view were to be adopted.

4. Arguments that “Purport”

Both the psychological and behavioral approaches take some aspect of an agent (various mental states or behaviors, respectively) to be the decisive factor distinguishing deductive from inductive arguments. An alternative to these approaches, on the other hand, would be to take some feature of the arguments themselves to be the crucial consideration instead. One such proposal of this type states that if an argument purports to definitely establish its conclusion, it is a deductive argument, whereas if an argument purports only to provide good reasons in support of its conclusion, it is an inductive argument (Black 1967). Another way to express this view involves saying that an argument that aims at being logically valid is deductive, whereas an argument that aims merely at making its conclusion probable is an inductive argument (White 1989; Perry and Bratman 1999; Harrell 2016). The primary attraction of these “purporting” or “aiming” approaches is that they promise to sidestep the thorny problems with the psychological and behavioral approaches detailed above by focusing on a feature of arguments themselves rather than on the persons advancing them. However, they generate some puzzles of their own that are worth considering.

The puzzles at issue all concern the notion of an argument “purporting” (or “aiming”) to do something. One might argue that “purporting” is something that only intentional agents can do, either directly or indirectly. Skyrms (1975) makes this criticism with regard to arguments that are said to intend a conclusion with a certain degree of support. Someone, being the intentional agent they are, may purport to be telling the truth, or rather may purport to have more formal authority than they really possess, just to give a couple examples. The products of such intentional agents (sentences, behaviors, and the like) may be said to purport to do something, but they still in turn depend on what some intentional agent purports. Consequently, then, this “purporting” approach may collapse into a psychological or behavioral approach.

Suppose, however, that one takes arguments themselves to be the sorts of things that can purport to support their conclusions either conclusively or with strong probability. How does one distinguish the former type of argument from the latter, especially in cases in which it is not clear what the argument itself purports to show? Recall the example used previously: “Dom Pérignon is a champagne; so, it is made in France.” How strongly does this argument purport to support its conclusion? As already seen, this argument could be interpreted as purporting to show that the conclusion is logically entailed by the premise, since, by definition, “champagne” is a type of sparkling wine produced only in France. On the other hand, the argument could also be interpreted as purporting to show only that Dom Pérignon is probably made in France, since so much wine is produced in France. How does one know what an argument really purports?

One might attempt to answer this question by inferring that the argument’s purport is conveyed by certain indicator words. Words like “necessarily” may purport that the conclusion logically follows from the premises, whereas words like “probably” may purport that the conclusion is merely made probable by the premises. However, consider the following argument: “The economy will probably improve this year; so, necessarily, the economy will improve this year.” The word “probably” could be taken to indicate that this purports to be an inductive argument. The word “necessarily” could be taken to signal that this argument purports to be a deductive argument. So, which is it? One cannot strictly tell from these indicator words alone. Granted, this is indeed a very strange argument, but that is the point. What does the argument in question really purport, then? Certainly, despite issues of the argument’s validity or soundness, highlighting indicator words does not make it clear what it precisely purports. So, highlighting indicator words may not always be a helpful strategy, but to make matters more complicated, specifying that an argument purports to show something already from the beginning introduces an element of interpretation that is at odds with what was supposed to be the main selling point of this approach in the first place – that distinguishing deductive and inductive arguments depends solely on objective features of arguments themselves, rather than on agents’ intentions or interpretations.

5. Evidential Completeness

Another proposal for distinguishing deductive from inductive arguments with reference to features of arguments themselves focuses on evidential completeness. One might be told, for example, that an inductive argument is one that can be affected by acquiring new premises (evidence), but a deductive argument cannot be.” Or, one might be told that whereas the premises in a deductive argument “stand alone” to sufficiently support its conclusion, all inductive arguments have “missing pieces of evidence” (Teays 1996). This evidential completeness approach is distinct from the psychological approaches considered above, given that an argument could be affected (that is, it could be strengthened or weakened) by acquiring new premises regardless of anyone’s intentions or beliefs about the argument under consideration. It is also distinct from the behavioral views discussed above as well, given that an argument could be affected by acquiring new premises without anyone claiming or presenting anything about it. Finally, it is distinct from the “purporting” view, too, since whether an argument can be affected by acquiring additional premises has no evident connection with what an argument purports to show.

How well does such an evidential completeness approach work to categorically distinguish deductive and inductive arguments? Once again, examination of an example may help to shed light on some of the implications of this approach. Consider the following argument:

All men are mortal.
Therefore, Socrates is mortal.

On the evidential completeness approach, this cannot be a deductive argument because it can be affected by adding a new premise, namely “Socrates is a man.” The addition of this premise makes the argument valid, a characteristic of which only deductive arguments can boast. On the other hand, were one to acquire the premise “Socrates is a god,” this also would greatly affect the argument, specifically by weakening it. At least in this case, adding a premise makes a difference. Without the inclusion of the “Socrates is a man” premise, it would be considered an inductive argument. With the “Socrates is a man” premise, the argument is deductive. As such, then, the evidential completeness approach looks promising.

However, it is worth noticing that to say that a deductive argument is one that cannot be affected (that is, it cannot be strengthened or weakened) by acquiring additional evidence or premises, whereas an inductive argument is one that can be affected by additional evidence or premises, is to already begin with an evaluation of the argument in question, only then to proceed to categorize it as deductive or inductive. “Strengthening” and “weakening” are evaluative assessments. This is to say that, with the evidential completeness approach being considered here, the categorization follows rather than precedes argument analysis and evaluation. This is precisely the opposite of the traditional claim that categorizing an argument as deductive or inductive must precede its analysis and evaluation. If categorization follows rather than precedes evaluation, one might wonder what actual work the categorization is doing. Be that as it may, perhaps in addition to such concerns, there is something to be said with regard to the idea that deductive and inductive arguments may differ in the way that their premises relate to their conclusions. That is an idea that deserves to be examined more closely.

6. Logical Necessity vs. Probability

Govier (1987) observes that “Most logic texts state that deductive arguments are those that ‘involve the claim’ that the truth of the premises renders the falsity of the conclusion impossible, whereas inductive arguments ‘involve’ the lesser claim that the truth of the premises renders the falsity of the conclusion unlikely, or improbable.” Setting aside the “involve the claim” clause (which Govier rightly puts in scare quotes), what is significant about this observation is how deductive and inductive arguments are said to differ in the way in which their premises are related to their conclusions.

Anyone acquainted with introductory logic texts will find quite familiar many of the following characterizations, one of them being the idea of “necessity.” For example, McInerny (2012) states that “a deductive argument is one whose conclusion always follows necessarily from the premises.” An inductive argument, by contrast, is one whose conclusion is merely made probable by the premises. Stated differently, “A deductive argument is one that would be justified by claiming that if the premises are true, they necessarily establish the truth of the conclusion” (Churchill 1987). Similarly, “deductive arguments … are arguments whose premises, if true, guarantee the truth of the conclusion” (Bowell and Kemp 2015). Or, one may be informed that in a valid deductive argument, anyone who accepts the premises is logically bound to accept the conclusion, whereas inductive arguments are never such that one is logically bound to accept the conclusion, even if one entirely accepts the premises (Solomon 1993). Furthermore, one might be told that a valid deductive argument is one in which it is impossible for the conclusion to be false given its true premises, whereas that is possible for an inductive argument.

Neidorf (1967) says that in a valid deductive argument, the conclusion certainly follows from the premises, whereas in an inductive argument, it probably does. Likewise, Salmon (1963) explains that in a deductive argument, if all the premises are true, the conclusion must be true, whereas in an inductive argument, if all the premises are true, the conclusion is only probably true. In a later edition of the same work, he says that “We may summarize by saying that the inductive argument expands upon the content of the premises by sacrificing necessity, whereas the deductive argument achieves necessity by sacrificing any expansion of content” (Salmon 1984).

Another popular approach along the same lines is to say that “the conclusion of a deductively valid argument is already ‘contained’ in the premises,” whereas inductive arguments have conclusions that “go beyond what is contained in their premises” (Hausman, Boardman, and Howard 2021). Likewise, one might be informed that “In a deductive argument, the … conclusion makes explicit a bit of information already implicit in the premises … Deductive inference involves the rearranging of information.” By contrast, “The conclusion of an inductive argument ‘goes beyond’ the premises” (Churchill 1986). A similar idea is expressed by saying that whereas deductive arguments are “demonstrative,” inductive arguments “outrun” their premises (Rescher 1976). The image one is left with in such presentations is that in deductive arguments, the conclusion is “hidden in” the premises, waiting there to be “squeezed” out of them, whereas the conclusion of an inductive argument has to be supplied from some other source. In other words, deductive arguments, in this view, are explicative, whereas inductive arguments are ampliative. These are all interesting suggestions, but their import may not yet be clear. Such import must now be made explicit.

7. The Question of Validity

Readers may have noticed in the foregoing discussion of such “necessitarian” characterizations of deductive and inductive arguments that whereas some authors identify deductive arguments as those whose premises necessitate their conclusions, others are careful to limit that characterization to valid deductive arguments. After all, it is only in valid deductive arguments that the conclusion follows with logical necessity from the premises. A different way to put it is that only in valid deductive arguments is the truth of the conclusion guaranteed by the truth of the premises; or, to use yet another characterization, only in valid deductive arguments do those who accept the premises find themselves logically bound to accept the conclusion. One could say that it is impossible for the conclusion to be false given that the premises are true, or that the conclusion is already contained in the premises (that is, the premises are necessarily truth-preserving). Thus, strictly speaking, these various necessitarian proposals apply only to a distinction between valid deductive arguments and inductive arguments.

Some authors appear to embrace such a conclusion. McIntyre (2019) writes the following:

Deductive arguments are and always will be valid because the truth of the premises is sufficient to guarantee the truth of the conclusion; if the premises are true, the conclusion will be also. This is to say that the truth of the conclusion cannot contain any information that is not already contained in the premises.

By contrast, he mentions that “With inductive arguments, the conclusion contains information that goes beyond what is contained in the premises.” Such a stance might well be thought to be no problem at all. After all, if an argument is valid, it is necessarily deductive; if it isn’t valid, then it is necessarily inductive. The notion of validity, therefore, appears to neatly sort arguments into either of the two categorically different argument types – deductive or inductive. Validity, then, may be the answer to the problems thus far mentioned.

There is, however, a cost to this tidy solution. Many philosophers want to say not only that all valid arguments are deductive, but also that not all deductive arguments are valid, and that whether a deductive argument is valid or invalid depends on its logical form. In other words, they want to leave open the possibility of there being invalid deductive arguments. The psychological approaches already considered do leave open this possibility, since they distinguish deductive and inductive arguments in relation to an arguer’s intentions and beliefs, rather than in relation to features of arguments themselves. Notice, however, that on the necessitarian proposals now being considered, there can be no invalid deductive arguments. “Deduction,” in this account, turns out to be a success term. There are no bad deductive arguments, at least so far as logical form is concerned (soundness being an entirely different matter). Consequently, if one adopts one of these necessitarian accounts, claims like the following must be judged to be simply incoherent: “A bad, or invalid, deductive argument is one whose form or structure is such that instances of it do, on occasion, proceed from true premises to a false conclusion” (Bergmann, Moor, and Nelson 1998). If deductive arguments are identical with valid arguments, then an “invalid deductive argument” is simply impossible: there cannot be any such type of argument. Salmon (1984) makes this point explicit, and even embraces it. Remarkably, he also extends automatic success to all bona fide inductive arguments, telling readers that “strictly speaking, there are no incorrect deductive or inductive arguments; there are valid deductions, correct inductions, and assorted fallacious arguments.” Essentially, therefore, one has a taxonomy of good and bad arguments.

Pointing out these consequences does not show that the necessitarian approach is wrong, however. One might simply accept that all deductive arguments are valid, and that all inductive arguments are strong, because “to be valid” and “to be strong” are just what it means to be a deductive or an inductive argument, respectively. One must then classify bad arguments as neither deductive nor inductive. An even more radical alternative would be to deny that bad “arguments” are arguments at all.

Still, to see why one might find these consequences problematic, consider the following argument:

If P, then Q.
Q.
Therefore, P.

This argument form is known as “affirming the consequent.” It is identified in introductory logic texts as a logical fallacy. In colloquial terms, someone may refer to a widely-accepted but false belief as a “fallacy.” In logic, however, a fallacy is not a mistaken belief. Rather, it is a mistaken form of inference. Arguments can fail as such in at least two distinct ways: their premises can be false (or unclear, incoherent, and so on), and the connection between the premises and conclusion can be defective. In logic, a fallacy is a failure of the latter sort. Introductory logic texts usually classify fallacies as either “formal” or “informal.” An ad hominem (Latin for “against the person”) attack is a classic informal fallacy. By contrast, “affirming the consequent,” such as the example above, is classified as a formal fallacy.

How are these considerations relevant to the deductive-inductive argument distinction under consideration? On the proposal being considered, the argument above in which “affirming the consequent” is exhibited cannot be a deductive argument, indeed not even a bad one, since it is manifestly invalid, given that all deductive arguments are necessarily valid. Rather, since the premises do not necessitate the conclusion, it must be an inductive argument. This is the case unless one follows Salmon (1984) in saying that it is neither deductive nor inductive but, being an instance of affirming the consequent, it is simply fallacious.

Perhaps it is easy to accept such a consequence. Necessitarian proposals are not out of consideration yet, however. Part of the appeal of such proposals is that they seem to provide philosophers with an understanding of how premises and conclusions are related to one another in valid deductive arguments. Is this a useful proposal after all?

Consider the idea that in a valid deductive argument, the conclusion is already contained in the premises. What might this mean? Certainly, all the words that appear in the conclusion of a valid argument need not appear in its premises. Rather, what is supposed to be contained in the premises of a valid argument is the claim expressed in its conclusion. This is the case given that in a valid argument the premises logically entail the conclusion. So, it can certainly be said that the claim expressed in the conclusion of a valid argument is already contained in the premises of the argument, since the premises entail the conclusion. Has there thus been any progress made in understanding validity?

To answer that question, consider the following six arguments, all of which are logically valid:

P.	P.	P and not P.
Therefore, P.	Therefore, either Q or not Q.	Therefore, Q.

P.	P.	P.
Therefore, P or Q.	Therefore, if Q then Q.	Therefore, if not P, then Q.

In any of these cases (except the first), is it at all obvious how the conclusion is contained in the premise? Insofar as the locution “contained in” is supposed to convey an understanding of validity, such accounts fall short of such an explicative ambition. This calls into question the aptness of the “contained in” metaphor for explaining the relationship between premises and conclusions regarding valid arguments.

8. Formalization and Logical Rules to the Rescue?

In the previous section, it was assumed that some arguments can be determined to be logically valid simply in virtue of their abstract form. After all, the “P”s and “Q”s in the foregoing arguments are just variables or placeholders. It is the logical form of those arguments that determines whether they are valid or invalid. Rendering arguments in symbolic form helps to reveal their logical structure. Might not this insight provide a clue as to how one might categorically distinguish deductive and inductive arguments? Perhaps it is an argument’s capacity or incapacity for being rendered in symbolic form that distinguishes an argument as deductive or inductive, respectively.

To assess this idea, consider the following argument:

If today is Tuesday, we’ll be having tacos for lunch.
Today is Tuesday.
So, we’ll be having tacos for lunch.

This argument is an instance of the valid argument form modus ponens, which can be expressed symbolically as:

P → Q.
P.
∴ Q.

Any argument having this formal structure is a valid deductive argument and automatically can be seen as such. Significantly, according to the proposal that deductive but not inductive arguments can be rendered in symbolic form, a deductive argument need not instantiate a valid argument form. Recall the fallacious argument form known as “affirming the consequent”:

If P, then Q.
Q.
Therefore, P.

It, too, can be rendered in purely symbolic notation:

P → Q.
Q.
∴ P.

Consequently, this approach would permit one to say that deductive arguments may be valid or invalid, just as some philosophers would wish. It might be thought, on the other hand, that inductive arguments do not lend themselves to this sort of formalization. They are just too polymorphic to be represented in purely formal notation.

Note, however, that the success of this proposal depends on all inductive arguments being incapable of being represented formally. Unfortunately for this proposal, however, all arguments, both deductive and inductive, are capable of being rendered in formal notation. For example, consider the following argument:

We usually have tacos for lunch on Tuesdays.
Today is Tuesday.
So, we’re probably having tacos for lunch.

In other words, given that today is Tuesday, there is a better than even chance that tacos will be had for lunch. This might be rendered formally as:

P(A/B) > 0.5

It must be emphasized that the point here is not that this is the only or even the best way to render the argument in question in symbolic form. Rather, the point is that inductive arguments, no less than deductive arguments, can be rendered symbolically, or, at the very least, the burden of proof rests on deniers of this claim. But, if so, then it seems that the capacity for symbolic formalization cannot categorically distinguish deductive from inductive arguments.

Another approach would be to say that whereas deductive arguments involve reasoning from one statement to another by means of logical rules, inductive arguments defy such rigid characterization (Solomon 1993). In this view, identifying a logical rule governing an argument would be sufficient to show that the argument is deductive. Failure to identify such a rule governing an argument, however, would not be sufficient to demonstrate that the argument is not deductive, since logical rules may nonetheless be operative but remain unrecognized.

The “reasoning” clause in this proposal is also worth reflecting upon. Reasoning is something that some rational agents do on some occasions. Strictly speaking, arguments, consisting of sentences lacking cognition, do not reason (recall that earlier a similar point was considered regarding the idea of arguments purporting something). Consequently, the “reasoning” clause is ambiguous, since it may mean either that: (a) there is a logical rule that governs (that is, justifies, warrants, or the like) the inference from the premise to the conclusion; or (b) some cognitional agent either explicitly or implicitly uses a logical rule to reason from one statement (or a set of statements) to another.

If the former, more generous interpretation is assumed, it is easy to see how this suggestion might work with respect to deductive arguments. Consider the following argument:

If today is Tuesday, then the taco truck is here.
The taco truck is not here.
Therefore, today is not Tuesday.

This argument instantiates the logical rule modus tollens:

If P, then Q.	P → Q
Not Q.	~ Q
Therefore, not P.	∴ ~ P

Perhaps all deductive arguments explicitly or implicitly rely upon logical rules. However, for this proposal to categorically distinguish deductive from inductive arguments, it must be the case both that all deductive arguments embody logical rules, and that no inductive arguments do.

Is this true? It is not entirely clear. A good case can be made that all valid deductive arguments embody logical rules (such as modus ponens or modus tollens). However, if one wants to include some invalid arguments within the set of all deductive arguments, then it is hard to see what logical rules could underwrite invalid argument types such as affirming the consequent or denying the antecedent. It would seem bizarre to say that in inferring “P” from “If P, then Q” and “Q” that one relied upon the logical rule “affirming the consequent.” That is not a logical rule. It is a classic logical fallacy.

Likewise, consider the following argument that many would consider to be an inductive argument:

Nearly all individuals polled in a random sample of registered voters contacted one week before the upcoming election indicated that they would vote to re-elect Senator Blowhard. Therefore, Senator Blowhard will be re-elected.

There may be any number of rules implicit in the foregoing inference. For example, the rule implicit in this argument might be something like this:

Random sampling of a relevant population’s voting preferences one week before an election provides good grounds for predicting that election’s results.

This is no doubt some sort of rule, even if it does not explicitly follow the more clear-cut logical rules thus far mentioned. Is the above the right sort of rule, however? Perhaps deductive arguments are those that involve reasoning from one statement to another by means of deductive rules. One could then stipulate what those deductive logical rules are, such that they exclude rules like the one implicit in the ostensibly inductive argument above. This would resolve the problem of distinguishing between deductive and inductive arguments, but at the cost of circularity (that is, by committing a logical fallacy).

If one objected that the inductive rule suggested above is a formal rule, then a formal version of the rule could be devised. However, if that is right, then the current proposal stating that deductive arguments, but not inductive ones, involve reasoning from one statement to another by means of logical rules is false. Inductive arguments rely, or at least can rely, upon logical rules as well.

9. Other Even Less Promising Proposals

A perusal of introductory logic texts turns up a hodgepodge of other proposals for categorically distinguishing deductive and inductive arguments that, upon closer inspection, seem even less promising than the proposals surveyed thus far. One example will have to suffice.

Kreeft (2005) says that whereas deductive arguments begin with a “general” or “universal” premise and move to a less general conclusion, inductive arguments begin with “particular”, “specific”, or “individual” premises and move to a more general conclusion.

In light of this proposal, consider again the following argument:

All men are mortal.
Socrates is a man.
Therefore, Socrates is mortal.

As mentioned already, this argument is the classic example used in introductory logic texts to illustrate a deductive argument. It moves from a general (or universal) premise (exhibited by the phrase “all men”) to a specific (or particular) conclusion (exhibited by referring to “Socrates”). By contrast, consider the following argument:

Each spider so far examined has had eight legs.
Therefore, all spiders have eight legs.

This argument moves from specific instances (demarcated by the phrase “each spider so far examined”) to a general conclusion (as seen by the phrase “all spiders”). Therefore, on this proposal, this argument would be inductive.

So far, so good. However, this approach seems much too crude for drawing a categorical distinction between the deductive and inductive arguments. Consider the following argument:

All As are Bs.
All Bs are Cs.
Therefore, all As are Cs.

On this account, this would be neither deductive nor inductive, since it involves only universal statements. Likewise, consider the following as well:

Each spider so far examined has had eight legs.
Therefore, likewise, the next spider examined will have eight legs.

According to Kreeft’s proposal, this would be neither a deductive nor an inductive argument, since it moves from a number of particulars to yet another particular. What kind of argument, then, may this be considered as? Despite the ancient pedigree of Kreeft’s proposal (since he ultimately draws upon both Platonic and Aristotelian texts), and the fact that one still finds it in some introductory logic texts, it faces such prima facie plausible exceptions that it is hard to see how it could be an acceptable, much less the best, view for categorically distinguishing between deductive and inductive arguments.

10. An Evaluative Approach

There have been many attempts to distinguish deductive from inductive arguments. Some approaches focus on the psychological states (such as the intentions, beliefs, or doubts) of those advancing an argument. Others focus on the objective behaviors of arguers by focusing on what individuals claim about or how they present an argument. Still others focus on features of arguments themselves, such as what an argument purports, its evidential completeness, its capacity for formalization, or the nature of the logical bond between its premises and conclusion. All of these proposals entail problems of one sort or another. The fact that there are so many radically different views about what distinguishes deductive from inductive arguments is itself noteworthy, too. This fact might not be evident from examining the account given in any specific text, but it emerges clearly when examining a range of different proposals and approaches, as has been done in this article. The diversity of views on this issue has so far garnered remarkably little attention. Some authors (such as Moore and Parker 2004) acknowledge that the best way of distinguishing deductive from inductive arguments is “controversial.” Yet, there seems to be remarkably little actual controversy about it. Instead, matters persist in a state of largely unacknowledged chaos.

Rather than leave matters in this state of confusion, one final approach must be considered. Instead of proposing yet another account of how deductive and inductive arguments differ, this proposal seeks to dispense entirely with the entire categorical approach of the proposals canvassed above.

Without necessarily acknowledging the difficulties explored above or citing them as a rationale for taking a fundamentally different approach, some authors nonetheless decline to define “deductive” and “inductive” (or more generally “non-deductive”) arguments at all, and instead adopt an evaluative approach that focuses on deductive and inductive standards for evaluating arguments (see Skyrms 1975; Bergmann, Moor, and Nelson 1998). When presented with any argument, one can ask: “Does the argument prove its conclusion, or does it only render it probable, or does it do neither?” One can then proceed to evaluate the argument by first asking whether the argument is valid, that is, whether the truth of the conclusion is entailed by the truth of the premises. If the answer to this initial question is affirmative, one can then proceed to determine whether the argument is sound by assessing the actual truth of the premises. If the argument is determined to be sound, then its conclusion is ceteris paribus worth believing. If the argument is determined to be invalid, one can then proceed to ask whether the truth of the premises would make the conclusion probable. If it would, one can judge the argument to be strong. If one then determines or judges that the argument’s premises are probably true, the argument can be declared cogent. Otherwise, it ought to be declared not-cogent (or the like). In this latter case, one ought not to believe the argument’s conclusion on the strength of its premises.

What is noteworthy about this procedure is that at no time was it required to determine whether any argument is “deductive,” “inductive,” or more generally “non-deductive.” Such classificatory concepts played no role in executing the steps in the process of argument evaluation. Yet, the whole point of examining an argument in first place is nevertheless achieved with this approach. That is, the effort to determine whether an argument provides satisfactory grounds for accepting its conclusion is carried out successfully. In order to discover what one can learn from an argument, the argument must be treated as charitably as possible. By first evaluating an argument in terms of validity and soundness, and, if necessary, then in terms of strength and cogency, one gives each argument its best shot at establishing its conclusion, either with a very high degree of certainty or at least with a degree of probability. One will then be in a better position to determine whether the argument’s conclusion should be believed on the basis of its premises.

This is of course not meant to minimize the difficulties associated with evaluating arguments. Evaluating arguments can be quite difficult. However, insisting that one first determine whether an argument is “deductive” or “inductive” before proceeding to evaluate it seems to insert a completely unnecessary step in the process of evaluation that does no useful work on its own. Moreover, a focus on argument evaluation rather than on argument classification promises to avoid the various problems associated with the categorical approaches discussed in this article. There is no need to speculate about the possibly unknowable intentions, beliefs, and/or doubts of someone advancing an argument. There is no need to guess at what an argument purports to show, or to ponder whether it can be formalized or represented by logical rules in order to determine whether one ought to believe the argument’s conclusion on the basis of its premises. In short, one does not need a categorical distinction between deductive and inductive arguments at all in order to successfully carry out argument evaluation..

This article is an attempt to practice what it preaches. Although there is much discussion in this article about deductive and inductive arguments, and a great deal of argumentation, there was no need to set out a categorical distinction between deductive and inductive arguments in order to critically evaluate a range of claims, positions, and arguments about the purported distinction between each type of argument. Hence, although such a distinction is central to the way in which argumentation is often presented, it is unclear what actual work it is doing for argument evaluation, and thus whether it must be retained. Perhaps it is time to give the deductive-inductive argument distinction its walking papers.

11. References and Further Reading

Aristotle. The Basic Works of Aristotle. New York: Random House, 1941.
Bacon, Francis. Francis Bacon: The Major Works. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2002.
Barry, Vincent E. The Critical Edge: Critical Thinking for Reading and Writing. Orlando, FL: Holt, Rinehart and Winston, Inc., 1992.
Bergmann, Merrie, James Moor and Jack Nelson. The Logic Book. 3rd ed. New York: McGraw-Hill, 1998.
Black, Max. “Induction.” The Encyclopedia of Philosophy. Ed. Paul Edwards. Vol. 4. New York: Macmillan Publishing Co., Inc. & The Free Press, 1967. 169-181.
Bowell, Tracy and Gary Kemp. Critical Thinking: A Concise Guide. 4th ed. London: Routledge, 2015.
Churchill, Robert Paul. Becoming Logical: An Introduction to Logic. New York: St. Martin’s Press, 1986.
Copi, Irving. Introduction to Logic. 5th ed. New York: Macmillan, 1978.
Descartes, René. A Discourse on the Method. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2006.
Einstein, Albert. “Induction and Deduction in Physics.” Einstein, Albert. The Collected Papers of Albert Einstein: The Berlin Years: Writings, 1918-1921. Trans. Alfred Engel. Vol. 7. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 2002. 108-109. <https://einsteinpapers.press.princeton.edu/vol7-trans/124>.
Engel, S. Morris. With Good Reason: An Introduction to Informal Fallacies. 5th ed. New York: St. Martin’s Press, 1994.
Govier, Trudy. Problems in Argument Analysis and Evaluation. Updated Edition. Windsor: Windsor Studies in Argumentation, 1987.
Haack, Susan. Philosophy of Logics. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1978.
Harrell, Maralee. What is the Argument? An Introduction to Philosophical Argument and Analysis. Cambridge: The MIT Press, 2016.
Hausman, Alan, Frank Boardman and Kahane Howard. Logic and Philosophy: A Modern Introduction. 13th ed. Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing, 2021.
Hurley, Patrick J. and Lori Watson. A Concise Introduction to Logic. 13th ed. Belmont: Cengage Learning, 2018.
Kreeft, Peter. Socratic Logic: A Logic Text Using Socratic Method, Platonic Questions, and Aristotelian Principles. 2nd ed. South Bend: St. Augustine’s Press, 2005.
McInerny, D. Q. An Introduction to Foundational Logic. Elmhurst Township: The Priestly Fraternity of St. Peter, 2012.
McIntyre, Lee. The Scientific Attitude: Defending Science from Denial, Fraud, and Pseudoscience. Cambridge: The MIT Press, 2019.
Moore, Brooke Noel and Richard Parker. Critical Thinking. 7th ed. New York:: McGraw Hill, 2004.
Neidorf, Robert. Deductive Forms: An Elementary Logic. New York: Harper and Row, 1967.
Olson, Robert G. Meaning and Argument. New York: Harcourt, Brace, and World, 1975.
Perry, John and Michael Bratman. Introduction to Philosophy: Classical and Contemporary Readings. 3rd ed. New York: Oxford University Press, 1999.
Rescher, Nicholas. Plausible Reasoning. Assen: Van Gorcum, 1976.
Salmon, Wesley. Logic. Englewood Cliffs: Prentice Hall, 1963.
Salmon, Wesley. Logic. 3rd ed. Englewood Cliffs: Prentice Hall, 1984.
Skyrms, Brian. Choice and Chance. 2nd ed. Encino: Dikenson, 1975.
Solomon, Robert C. Introducing Philosophy: A Text with Integrated Readings. 5th ed. Fort Worth: Harcourt Brace Jovanovich, 1993.
Teays, Wanda. Second Thoughts: Critical Thinking from a Multicultural Perspective. Mountain View: Mayfield Publishing Company, 1996.
Vaughn, Lewis. The Power of Critical Thinking: Effective Reasoning about Ordinary and Extraordinary Claims. 3rd ed. New York: Oxford University Press, 2010.
White, James E. Introduction to Philosophy. St. Paul: West Publishing Company, 1989.

Author Information:
Timothy Shanahan
Email: timothy.shanahan@lmu.edu
Loyola Marymount University
U. S. A.

Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy