Skeptical Theism

Skeptical theism is the view that God exists but that we should be skeptical of our ability to discern God’s reasons for acting or refraining from acting in any particular instance.  In particular, says the skeptical theist, we should not grant that our inability to think of a good reason for doing or allowing something is indicative of whether or not God might have a good reason for doing or allowing something.  If there is a God, he knows much more than we do about the relevant facts, and thus it would not be surprising at all if he has reasons for doing or allowing something that we cannot fathom.

If skeptical theism is true, it appears to undercut the primary argument for atheism, namely the argument from evil.  This is because skeptical theism provides a reason to be skeptical of a crucial premise in the argument from evil, namely the premise that asserts that at least some of the evils in our world are gratuitous.  If we are not in a position to tell whether God has a reason for allowing any particular instance of evil, then we are not in a position to judge whether any of the evils in our world are gratuitous.  And if we cannot tell whether any of the evils in our world are gratuitous, then we cannot appeal to the existence of gratuitous evil to conclude that God does not exist.  The remainder of this article explains skeptical theism more fully, applies it to the argument from evil, and surveys the reasons for and against being a skeptical theist.

Table of Contents

  1. Introduction to Skeptical Theism
  2. The Argument from Evil
  3. Responses to the Argument from Evil
    1. Denying the Minor Premise
    2. Skepticism about the Minor Premise
  4. Defenses of Skeptical Theism
    1. Arguments from Analogy
    2. Arguments from Complexity
    3. Arguments from Enabling Premises
  5. Objections to Skeptical Theism
    1. Implications for the Divine-Human Relationship
    2. Implications for Everyday Knowledge
    3. Implications for Commonsense Epistemology
    4. Implications for Moral Theory
    5. Implications for Moral Living
  6. References and Further Reading

1. Introduction to Skeptical Theism

Skeptical theism is a conjunction of two theses.  The first thesis of skeptical theism is that theism is true, where “theism” is roughly the view that God exists and “God,” in turn, is an honorific title describing the most perfect being possible.  This is the being putatively described in classical western theologies of Judaism, Christianity, Islam, and some theistic forms of Eastern religions.  The second thesis is that a certain limited form of skepticism is true, where this skepticism applies to the ability of humans to make all-things-considered judgments about what God would do or allow in any particular situation.  Not all theists are skeptical theists, and not all of the philosophers who endorse the skeptical component of skeptical theism are theists.  Since it is the skeptical component that is of most interest, it will be the focus in what follows.

It is important to get clear on the scope of the skepticism endorsed by skeptical theists.  First, it is not a global skepticism—skeptical theists are not committed to the view that we cannot know anything at all.  Instead, the skepticism is (putatively) limited to a narrow range of propositions, namely those having to do with God’s reasons for action.  For example, a skeptical theist could admit that humans have ceteris paribus knowledge of God’s reasons for actions.  An example of such knowledge might be the following: other-things-being-equal, God will eliminate suffering when he is able to do so.  However, knowing this latter claim is consistent with denying that we know the following: God will eliminate this particular instance of suffering.  Holding the combination of these two views is possible for the following reason: while we might know that other-things-being-equal, God will eliminate suffering when he is able to do so, we might not know whether or not other things are equal in any particular instance of suffering.

As an example of this limited sort of skepticism, consider a much more mundane example.  One might know that other-things-being-equal, it is better to save aces in a hand of draw poker (since aces are the highest denomination).  However, one might know this while at the same time withholding judgment on whether or not it is a good idea for Jones to save aces in any particular hand, since one would not know what Jones’ other cards were (for example, perhaps saving an ace requires discarding a member of a four-of-a-kind set in another denomination).

2. The Argument from Evil

Agnosticism is the philosophical view that neither affirms that God exists nor affirms that God does not exist.  On the other hand, atheism is the view that God does not exist.  Perhaps the most powerful argument for atheism is the argument from evil.  According to this line of reasoning, the fact that the world contains evil is powerful evidence that God does not exist.  This is because God is supposed to be the most perfect being possible, and among these perfections is both perfect power and perfect goodness.  If God were perfectly powerful, then he would be able to eliminate all instances of evil.  If God were perfectly good, then he would want to eliminate all instances of evil.  Thus, if God exists, there would be no evil.  But there is evil.  Therefore, God does not exist.

While the foregoing sketches the rough terrain, the argument from evil comes in two distinct forms.  First is the logical problem of evil.  According to the logical problem of evil, it is not logically possible for both evil and God to coexist.  Any world in which God exists will be a world devoid of any evil.  Thus, anyone who believes both that God exists and that evil exists is committed to an implicit contradiction.

Second is the evidential argument from evil. According to the evidential argument from evil, while it is logically possible that both God and evil coexist, the latter is evidence against the former.  The evidential argument is sometimes put in terms of an inference to the best explanation (that is, the abductive argument from evil) and sometimes in terms of probabilities (that is, the inductive argument from evil).  In either case, certain facts about the existence, nature and distribution of evils in the world are offered as pro tanto evidence against the truth of theism.  This article focuses on the probabilistic (inductive) version of the evidential argument from evil as it is the most common in the contemporary literature.

It is widely conceded that there is no logical problem of evil for the following reason: if there is a God, he would allow any particular instance of evil that is necessary either to avoid some evil equally bad or worse or to secure some compensating (or justifying) good.  For instance, the experience of pain is an intrinsic evil.  However, the fact that a human father allows his child to experience the pain of an inoculation does not thereby show that the father is not perfectly good.  That is because, although evil in itself, the pain was necessary to secure a compensating good, namely being immune to a painful or deadly disease.  Philosophers call any instance of evil that is not necessary either to avoid some evil equally bad or worse or to secure some compensating (or justifying) good a gratuitous evil.  Thus, it is only the existence of gratuitous evil (instead of any evil whatsoever) that poses a (putative) problem for theism.

With the distinction between gratuitous and non-gratuitous evil in hand, the evidential argument from evil can be formulated as follows:

1. If God exists, then there are no instances of gratuitous evil.

2. It is likely that at least some instances of evil are gratuitous.

3. Therefore, it is likely that God does not exist.

The gist is that insofar as we have reason to believe that at least some of the evils in our world are not necessary either to avoid some evil equally bad or worse or to secure some compensating (or justifying) good, we have reason to believe that God does not exist.  So there is still a sense in which a logical problem of evil remains—it is logically impossible that God and gratuitous evil coexist.  The evidential nature of this argument focuses around premise (2): the best we can do is to present an inductive case for the claim that any particular evil in our world is gratuitous.

3. Responses to the Argument from Evil

Theists have challenged both premises in the argument from evil.  Regarding premise (1), some have challenged the notion that God is required by his moral perfection to eliminate all instances of gratuitous evil (for example, Van Inwagen 2003).  However, by and large, theists have focused their attention on the minor premise: the claim that it is likely that some of the evils in our world are gratuitous.  There are two ways of responding to this premise.  One may either deny it or seek to show that we should be agnostic about it.  Each strategy is sketched below.

a. Denying the Minor Premise

Challenges to the argument from evil that purport to show that premise (2) is false are typically called theodicies.  A theodicy is an attempt to show that no actual evil in our world is gratuitous, or, in logically equivalent terms, that all the evils in our world are necessary either to avoid some evil equally bad or worse or to secure some compensating (or justifying) good.  If a theist can successfully show this, then premise (2) in the argument from evil is false, and the argument from evil is unsound.

Theodicies take a number of different forms.  Some try to show that the evils in our world are necessary for compensating goods such as moral development, significant free will, and so on.  Others try to show that evils in our world are necessary to avoid evils equally bad or worse.  In either case, a successful theodicy will have to be thorough—if even one instance of evil in the world turns out to be gratuitous, the minor premise is true and the argument from evil goes through.

b. Skepticism about the Minor Premise

The burden of proof for a theodicy is tremendously high.  The theodicist must show that all of the evils in our world are non-gratuitous.  For this reason, many theistic philosophers prefer only to show that we should be agnostic about premise (2).  Skepticism about premise (2) is typically defended in one of two ways: by appeal to a defense or by appeal to the resources of skeptical theism.

Unlike a theodicy, a defense does not attempt to show what God’s actual reason is for allowing any particular instance of evil.  Instead, it attempts to show what God’s reasons might be for all we know.  And if God might have reasons for allowing a particular evil that we do not know about, then we are in no position to endorse premise (2) in the evidential argument from evil.  The idea is that there are relevant alternatives that we are in no position to rule out, and unless we are in such a position, we should not conclude that the minor premise is true.

For example, suppose you are a jurist in a criminal case, and—given only the videotape evidence—you cannot determine whether the defendant or his twin committed the crime.  In this case, you are not justified in concluding that the defendant is guilty, and that is because there is a live possibility that you cannot rule out, and this possibility would show that the defendant is innocent.  The same might be said of premise (2) in the argument from evil: there are live possibilities that we are in no position to rule out, and these possibilities show that God is justified in allowing the evils in our world.  And if so, we are in no position to endorse premise (2) of the argument from evil.

Skeptical theism provides a second, independent case for agnosticism about premise (2).  This case takes the form of an undercutting defeater for the standard defense of premise (2).  Why should we think that it is likely that at least some of the evils in our world are gratuitous?  The standard defense of this claim is as follows:

Well, it seems like many of the evils in our world are gratuitous, so it is likely that at least some instances of evil are gratuitous.

Put differently, we cannot see any reason for God to allow some of the evils in our world, therefore there we should conclude that there is no reason for God to allow some of the evils in our world.  Call this inference pattern the “noseeum” inference (“if we can’t see ‘um, they ain’t there”).

The skeptical theist denies the strength of this noseeum inference.  The fact that an evil appears to be gratuitous to us is not indicative of whether or not it is gratuitous.  So on the one hand, the skeptical theist is happy to grant that it seems as if many of the evils in our world are gratuitous.  However, she denies that this fact is good evidence for the claim that such evils really are gratuitous.  And hence we have no reason to endorse premise (2) in the argument from evil.

4. Defenses of Skeptical Theism

As a reply to the argument from evil, skeptical theism seems initially quite plausible.  Surely if there were a God, there would be many, many cases in which we could see no reason for a course of action although such reasons were available to God. Some things that look unjustifiable given our own perspectives are justifiable once one has all the facts.  Besides relying on this initial plausibility, skeptical theists have defended their view in roughly three ways.

a. Arguments from Analogy

The fact that a young child cannot discern a reason for her parents allowing her to suffer pain does not constitute a good reason for the young child to conclude that there are no such reasons.  In this case, a clear example of the noseeum inference fails.  Given the child’s limited knowledge and experience as compared to the knowledge and experience of her parents, she ought not conclude that her parents are not justified in allowing a certain evil to occur.  Other similar examples are easy to come by: if one does not play much chess, the fact that one cannot see why the chess master makes a particular move is not indicative of whether or not such a move is justified.  It would be silly to reason as follows: I cannot see a good reason for that move, therefore, there is no good reason for that move.

If these cases are persuasive, the skeptical theist can defend her position accordingly.  The cognitive distance between a young child and her parents is analogous to the cognitive position between a human agent and God.  Thus, the fact that a human is unable to see a reason for allowing a particular evil is not a good reason for concluding that God would have no reason for allowing that evil.

b. Arguments from Complexity

On its face, premise (2) is very straightforward: it is very likely that at least some of the evils in our world are gratuitous.  But when we get clear on what that means, we see that this kind of judgment is extraordinarily complex.  It says, in effect, that we are able to identify some instances of evil which were not necessary either to avoid an evil equally bad or worse or to secure some compensating good.  How could we ever know such complex facts?  For example, consider the following:

On the night that Sir Winston Churchill was conceived, had Lady Randolph Churchill fallen asleep in a slightly different position, the precise pathway that each of the millions of spermatozoa took would have been slightly altered.  As a result…Sir Winston Churchill, as we knew him, would not have existed, with the likely result that the evolution of World War II would have been substantially different… (Durston 2000, p. 66)

On the face of it, it appears that it would not matter what position Lady Churchill sleeps in.  Put differently, it appears that there is no good reason to prefer her sleeping in one position rather than another.  But given the specifics of human reproduction, this assumption is unwarranted and—in this case—plausibly false.  So the fact that we cannot see a reason is not indicative of whether or not there is any such reason.  This same objection applies, mutatis mutandis, to the inference from “we can see no reason to allow this evil” to “there is no reason to allow this evil.”

c. Arguments from Enabling Premises

One of the most sophisticated defenses of skeptical theism insists that some sort of enabling premise must be reasonably believed before noseeum inferences are warranted and, further, that this enabling premise is not reasonably believed with regard to inferences about what God would allow.  Two such enabling premises have been proposed in the literature: the first concerns our sensitivity to evidence and the second concerns the representativeness of our inductive samples.

The most common instance of the sensitivity strategy invokes an epistemic principle dubbed the Condition on Reasonable Epistemic Access, or “CORNEA” for short (Wyskstra 1984).  CORNEA says that inferences from “I see no X” to “There is no X” are justified only if it is reasonable to believe that if there were an X, I would likely see it.  So, for example, the inference from “I see no elephant in my office” to “There is no elephant in my office” is licensed by CORNEA since I reasonably believe that if there were an elephant in my office, I would likely see it.  However, such skeptical theists have insisted that it is not reasonable for me to think that if there were a reason for allowing any particular evil that I would be aware of it.  Given this assumption, CORNEA says that the inference from “I see no reason for allowing this instance of evil” to “There is no reason for allowing this instance of evil” is invalid.

The second strategy has to do with our knowledge of the representativeness of the inductive sample used in the noseeum inference.  According to this version of the strategy, the inductive move from “I see no X” to “There is no X” is warranted only if it is reasonable for me to believe that my inductive sample of X’s is representative of the whole.  For example, one should not rely on inductive evidence to conclude that all crows are black unless it is reasonable to assume that one’s sample of crows is representative of all crows.  As applied to the argument from evil, the inference from “I can see no reason to allow this evil” to “There is no reason to allow this evil” is justified only if it is reasonable for one to believe that the sample of reasons currently understood is representative of all of the reasons that are.  The crucial question then becomes whether or not any of us have good reason to think that our sample of goods, evils, and the connections between them is suitably representative.  Some philosophers think that we do have such reason (for example, Tooley 1991).  Others think that our knowledge is not representative (for example, Sennett 1993).  Others think we cannot tell one way or the other whether our sample is representative, and thus we lack good reason for thinking that the sample is representative, as required by the second strategy (for example, Bergmann 2001).

5. Objections to Skeptical Theism

As with any form of skepticism, skeptical theism has its critics.  Some of these critics are theists who think that skeptical theism has unbecoming implications for issues of importance to theism (such as knowledge of God, relationship with God, and the like).  Other critics think that skeptical theism has unbecoming implications for more general issues such as everyday knowledge, moral living, and so on.  The objections to skeptical theism fall roughly into five different sorts.

a. Implications for the Divine-Human Relationship

One prominent criticism of skeptical theism is that it eliminates the potential for a close relationship between humans and God.  It does so in two ways.  First, if skeptical theism undercuts arguments against the existence of God by highlighting the fact that we know very little about how God would act (all-things-considered), then by parity of reasoning it also undercuts arguments for the existence of God.  Skeptical theist considerations seem to suggest agnosticism about whether God would create a world, finely-tune the universe, create rational beings, and so on, despite the fact that each of these are assumptions in standard arguments for the existence of God.  And the same considerations appear to undercut our knowledge of God’s interactions in the world; it is no longer open to the theist to say what God wants in her life (all-things-considered), whether a particular event was a miracle, and so on.

Second, skeptical theism not only appears to undercut one’s knowledge of God, but it also seems to undercut one’s trust in God.  Being in a close relationship with another person requires some kind of understanding of what the other person wants and why the other person acts as she does.  Furthermore, communication is important to a relationship, but skeptical theists should not trust communication from God (including divine commands, mystical experiences, and so on).  Why?  Because for all we know, God has a reason for deceiving us that is beyond our ken.

b. Implications for Everyday Knowledge

Any non-global version of skepticism will face objections that attempt to stretch the skepticism to new areas of inquiry.  One objection of this sort claims that skeptical theism breaks down into a near-global skepticism that disallows what we might think of as everyday knowledge.  Consider the claim that all crows are black.  This seems a perfect example of everyday knowledge.  But a skeptical crowist might respond as follows: “for all we know, there are purple crows beyond our ken, thus, the fact that we see no purple crows is not indicative of the fact that there are no purple crows.”  Thus we do not know the claim that all crows are black.

c. Implications for Commonsense Epistemology

Others have argued not that skeptical theism is incompatible with any particular knowledge claim but that it is incompatible with a promising set of theories in epistemology.  In particular, skeptical theism appears to rule out so-called commonsense epistemologies that rely on something like the principle of credulity: other things being equal, it is reasonable to believe that things are as they appear.  The problem is that skeptical theists grant that at least some evils appear gratuitous, thus, by the principle of credulity, they ought to grant that it is reasonable to believe that at least some evils are gratuitous.  But that is precisely what skeptical theism denies.

d. Implications for Moral Theory

The skeptical theist’s strategy relies on the presumption that there are some moral judgments that we are not justified in making.  Consider an instance of childhood cancer.  The skeptical theist is unwilling to grant that this evil is gratuitous because—for all we know—it was necessary either to prevent some evil equally bad or worse or to secure some compensating good.  Furthermore, if the evil is not gratuitous, it seems that it would be morally permissible (or even morally obligatory) for God to allow that evil to occur.  This is how the skeptical theist hopes to get God off the hook: we cannot blame him for creating the actual world if he meets all of his moral obligations in doing so.

The putative problem is that the skeptical theist seems to be committed to a consequentialist view of ethics, and many philosophers find such a view unappealing.  The apparent implications result from the fact that a skeptical theist seems to allow that no matter how horrendous a particular instance of evil might be, it can always be justified given good enough consequences.  Thus, if one thinks that there are some things that morally ought not be allowed regardless of consequences (such as the torture of an innocent person), this putative implication counts against skeptical theism.

e. Implications for Moral Living

Finally, the most pressing objection to skeptical theism is that it seems to preclude both the possibility of engaging in moral deliberation and the possibility of moral knowledge.  The putative problem can be sketched as follows: if, for any instance of evil, we are unable to tell whether or not the evil is gratuitous, then we are unable to engage in moral deliberation and arrive at a view about what is reasonable for us to do.  For example, suppose a skeptical theist comes upon a young boy drowning in a pond.  His skeptical theism seems to commit him to reasoning as follows: for all I know, the boy’s death is necessary to prevent some greater evil or to secure some greater good, thus I do not have a reason to intervene.

Skeptical theists have offered a number of interesting responses to this objection.  Some think that what is wrong for a person depends only on what he or she knows, and thus it would be wrong for the bystander to let the boy drown since he does not know that the boy’s death is non-gratuitous.  Others think that what is right for God to allow might be different than what is right for us to allow.  In that case, it might be wrong for you to let the boy drown even though you cannot conclude (for skeptical theist reasons) that it is wrong for God to do the same.  Still others insist that there is no unique difficulty here: everyone faces the hurdle of attempting to decide whether a particular event will have, on balance, good or bad consequences.  In that case, though it is true that moral deliberation is difficult given skeptical theism, it is also difficult given any view of religious epistemology.

6. References and Further Reading

  • Almeida, M. & Oppy, G. (2003) “Sceptical Theism and Evidential Arguments from Evil,” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 81:4, pp. 496-516.
    • An objection to skeptical theism based on its implications for the moral life.
  • Alston, W. (1991) “The Inductive Argument from Evil and the Human Cognitive Condition,” Philosophical Perspectives 5, pp. 29-67.
    • A defense of skeptical theism by appeal to analogy.
  • Bergmann, M. (2001) “Skeptical Theism and Rowe’s New Evidential Argument from Evil,” Nous 35, pp. 278-296.
    • Seminal statement of skeptical theism and a defense of skeptical theism by appeal to enabling premises.
  • Draper, P. (1989) “Pain and Pleasure: An Evidential Problem for Theists,” Nous 23, pp. 331-350.
    • A concise statement of the abductive argument from evil.
  • Dougherty, T. (2008) “Epistemological Considerations Concerning Skeptical Theism,” Faith & Philosophy 25, pp. 172-176.
    • An objection to skeptical theism based on its implications for commonsense epistemology.
  • Durston, K. (2000) “The consequential complexity of history and gratuitous evil,” Religious Studies 36, pp. 65-80.
    • A defense of skeptical theism by appeal to complexity.
  • Hasker, W. (2004) “The sceptical solution to the problem of evil,” in Hasker, W. Providence, Evil, and the Openness of God (Routledge) pp. 43-57.
    • An example of an objection to skeptical theism by a theist
  • Hick, J. (1966) Evil and the God of Love (Harper & Rowe).
    • A clear presentation and defense of a soul-crafting theodicy.
  • Howard-Snyder, D. (2010) “Epistemic Humility, Arguments from Evil, and Moral Skepticism,”in Kvanvig, J. (ed.) Oxford Studies in Philosophy of Religion (Oxford: Oxford University Press) pp. 17-57.
    • Responding to an objection to skeptical theism based on its implications for moral living.
  • Jordan, J. (2006) “Does Skeptical Theism Lead to Moral Skepticism?” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 72, pp. 403-416.
    • An objection to skeptical theism based on its implications for moral living.
  • Mackie, J.L. (1955) “Evil and Omnipotence,” Mind 64:254, pp. 200-212.
    • The classic statement of the logical problem of evil.
  • McBrayer, J. (2010) “Skeptical Theism,” Philosophy Compass 4:1, pp. 1-13 (Blackwell).
    • A thorough review of the case for and against skeptical theism with an exhaustive bibliography.
  • McBrayer, J. (2009) “CORNEA and Inductive Evidence,” Faith & Philosophy 26:1, pp. 77-86.
    • An objection to the defense of skeptical theism by appeal to enabling premises
  • Plantinga, A. (1974) God, Freedom, and Evil (Eerdmans).
    • The classic response to the logical problem of evil.
  • Rowe, W. (2001) “Skeptical Theism: A Response to Bergmann,” Nous 35, pp. 297-303.
    • An objection to the defense of skeptical theism by appeal to analogies and enabling premises.
  • Rowe, W. (1979) “The Problem of Evil and Some Varieties of Atheism,” American Philosophical Quarterly 16, pp. 335-41.
    • A clear and classic statement of the evidential argument from evil.
  • Sennett, J. (1993) “The Inscrutable Evil Defense against the Inductive Argument from Evil,” Faith & Philosophy 10, pp. 220-229.
    • A defense of skeptical theism by appeal to enabling premises.
  • Tooley, M. (1991) “The Argument from Evil,” Philosophical Perspectives 5, pp. 89-134.
    • An objection to the defense of skeptical theism by appeal to enabling premises.
  • Trakakis, N. (2003) “Evil and the complexity of history: a response to Durston,” Religious     Studies 39, pp. 451-458.
    • An objection to the defense of skeptical theism by appeal to complexity.
  • Van Inwagen, P. (2003) The Problem of Evil (Oxford University Press).
    • A clear presentation of the argument from evil (§2) and an example of a defense.
  • Wilks, I. (2009) “Skeptical Theism and Empirical Unfalsifiability,” Faith & Philosophy 26:1, pp. 64-76.
    • An objection to skeptical theism based on its implications for everyday knowledge.
  • Wykstra, S. (1984) “The Humean Obstacle to Evidential Arguments from Suffering: On Avoiding the Evils of ‘Appearance’,” International Journal of Philosophy of Religion 16, pp. 73-93.
    • A defense of skeptical theism by appeal to enabling premises.

Author Information

Justin P. McBrayer
Email: mcbrayer_j@fortlewis.edu
Fort Lewis College
U. S. A.

The American Environmental Justice Movement

The origin of the American environmental justice movement can be traced back to the emergence of the American Civil Rights movement of the 1960s, and more specifically to the U.S. Civil Rights Act of 1964.  The movement reached a new level with the emergence of Robert Bullard’s work entitled Dumping in Dixie in the 1990’s, which constituted a clarion call for environmental justice. Although environmentalism and the environmental justice movement are related, there is a difference.  Environmentalism is concerned with humanity’s adverse impact upon the environment, but proponents are primarily concerned with the impact of an unhealthy environment thrust upon a collective body of life, entailing both human and non-human existence, including in some instances plant life.  The efforts of the environmental justice movement differ from those of the environmentalist movement in that, at the heart of environmental injustice, there are issues of racism and socio-economic injustice.  Although environmentalism focuses upon and acknowledges the negative impact of humanity’s actions upon the environment, the environmental justice movement builds upon the philosophy and work of environmentalism by stressing the manner in which adversely impacting the environment in turn adversely impacts the population of that environment.

Table of Contents

  1. The Definition of Environmental Justice
  2. History of the Environmental Justice Movement
  3. Environmental Racism and Environmental Justice
  4. Principles of the Environmental Justice Movement
  5. Causes of Environmental Injustice
  6. Major Events in the Environmental Justice Movement
  7. Environmental Justice Policy and Law
  8. References and Further Reading
    1. Books
    2. Journals
    3. Governmental and Legal Publications

1. The Definition of Environmental Justice

Although the origin of the environmental justice movement is traced to the passing of the Civil Rights Act of 1964, Robert Bullard’s work entitled Dumping in Dixie published in the 1990’s is considered to be the first book addressing the reality of environmental injustice.  The work examines the widening economic, health and environmental disparities between racial groups and socioeconomic groups at the end of the twentieth and the beginning of the twenty-first centuries.  Bullard states that in writing the book he operated with the assumption that all Americans have a basic right to live, work, play, go to school and worship in a clean and healthy environment (DD, xii).  Bullard’s analysis in Dumping in Dixie “chronicles the emergence of the environmental justice movement in an effort to develop common strategies that are supportive of building sustainable African American communities and other people of color communities.”  (DD, xiii).

Bullard’s wife, a practicing attorney, suggested that he study the spatial location of all the municipal solid-waste disposal facilities in Houston, Texas. This was done as part of a class-action lawsuit filed by Bullard’s wife against the city of Houston, the State of Texas, and Browning Ferris Industries.  The lawsuit originated from a plan to site a municipal landfill in a suburban, middle-income neighborhood of single-family homeowners. The lawsuit became known as Bearn v. Southwestern Waste Management and was the first lawsuit in the United States charging environmental discrimination in waste facility location under the Civil Rights Act. The Northwood Manor neighborhood consisted of over 82 percent African American residents (DD, xii).

The emergence of the environmental justice movement is directly linked to the environmental movement.  Some contend that environmentalism and the environmental justice movement are so interrelated that the movement has essentially redefined the nature of environmentalism. According to Bullard, an environmental revolution is taking shape in the United States which “has touched communities of color from New York to California and from Florida to Alaska” and any location “where African Americans, Latinos, Asians, Pacific Islanders, and Native Americans live and comprise a major portion of the population” (CER, 7).  The influence of the environmental justice movement has broadened the spectrum of environmentalism to include what might be regarded as the trivialities of life, according to Bullard. This includes activities such as play and attending school. It also has implications for something as simple as where humans, animals and plants reside. Bullard points out that the environmental justice movement in the United States focuses upon a diversity of areas including wilderness and wildlife preservation, resource conservation, pollution abatement and population control (DD, 1). The environmental justice movement served to interrelate the physical, social, and cultural dimensions of human, non-human and plant existence under the rubric of environmentalism in general and environmental justice in particular.   (Bullard, 1999) The environmental justice movement has indirectly heightened concern not only for human existence, but also for animals and plant life.  The reality is that no single definition of environmental justice exists. However, a significant legal definition used by the Environmental Protection Agency describes environmental justice as:

[T]he fair treatment and meaningful involvement of all people regardless of race, ethnicity, income, national origin, or educational level with respect to the development, implementation and enforcement of environmental laws, regulations and policies. Fair treatment means that no population, due to policy or economic disempowerment, is forced to bear a disproportionate burden of the negative human health or environmental impacts of pollution or other environmental consequences resulting from industrial, municipal, and commercial operations or the execution of federal, state, local, and tribal programs and policies (EPA, 2).

The environmental justice movement is concerned with the pursuit of social justice and the preamble to the Principles of environmental justice adopted at the First National People of Color Environmental Leadership Summit in Washington D.C., 1991 reflects the primacy of this concern.  According to the environmental justice movement, all Americans, regardless of whether they are white or black, rich or poor, are entitled to equal protection under the law.  The  environmental justice advocates for quality education, employment, and housing, as well as the health of physical environments in which individuals, families and groups live (DD, 7).

While the environmental justice movement is rooted in significant philosophical/sociological underpinnings, the movement strives to be intensely practical. Few environmentalists realize the sociologic implications of what has been termed the “not-in-my-backyard” phenomenon which entails the recognition of the reality that hazardous waste, garbage dumps and polluting industries will inevitably be located in someone’s backyard.  The question then emerges as to whose and which backyards these toxic entities will be located? Bullard concluded based upon sociological analysis that these entities frequently end up in poor, powerless, black communities rather than affluent suburbs and he adds that this has been the case repeatedly (DD, 4).

It is important to note that the movement is critical of Western theories of jurisprudence and philosophy, which are founded upon Kantian, Cartesian and Lockean assumptions. For instance, Kantian jurisprudence is committed to the idea of the universality of rules in addressing a wide range of moral issues, whereas Cartesian dualism devalues the significance of physical existence and threats to that existence, and the philosophical conclusions of John Locke preserves individualism at the expense of the collective group. The environmental justice movement rejects each of these, concluding that no universal law or rule can be applied in a diversity of moral contexts, that the physical existence of a collective body is to be aggressively protected, and, finally, that no one individual or particular group is to be victimized for the benefit of another.  In short, such theories do not “embrace the whole community of life as the relevant moral community” (Rasmussen, 12).  Not only do these traditional philosophical underpinnings of the Western worldview fail to include members of the total human community, these approaches also fail to acknowledge the significance of life in the non-human sphere.

It is also important to note that environmental justice advocates reject the Rawlsian understanding of justice as “fairness”.  In acknowledging the reality of social, economic and moral inequity, Rawls argued that these inequities must be based upon the condition of benefit to the least advantaged. In the philosophy of the environmental justice movement, however, to adopt Rawls’ definition of justice and to tolerate the existence of actual instances of inequities and injustice based upon benefit to the collective victims reflects a perpetuation of centuries of oppression, which have become part and parcel of inadequate and distorted forms of institutional decision-making (Deane Drummond, 10). Furthermore, for environmental justice proponents, “justice is justice as distribution, recognition, and participation, linked in ways that address the wellbeing of the whole community of life in a given locale” (Rasmussen, 17).

Part of the uniqueness of the environmental justice movement is the focus on injustice as a collective experience.  Consequently, those in the movement strive for the actual pursuit, promotion, and establishment of better living conditions in the midst of collective entities, both human and non-human.  As such, at its very core the environmental justice movement is transformational and strives to empower collective victims of environmental injustice with the capacity for self-provision, self-organization, and self-governance (Rasmussen, 17).

In addition and as previously indicated, there is an important distinction to be made between environmentalism and the environmental justice movement.  While environmentalism is concerned with environmental injustice and the pursuit of justice, it is primarily concerned with the abuse of the environment by a hierarchical model which places humanity at the top with the result being the abuse of nature.  On the other hand, environmental justice advocates are more concerned with what is termed “social ecology” or “human welfare ecology.” Their primary concern is the impact of institutional systemic flaws which are the natural result of a progression of historical events resulting in decisions which establish unjust living conditions upon one group of people due to a lack of organization, power and prominence. At the risk of oversimplification, whereas environmentalism is concerned with humanity’s adverse impact upon the environment, environmental justice proponents are primarily concerned with the impact of an unhealthy environment thrust upon a collective body of life, both human and non-human, including in some instances plant life. The efforts of the environmental justice movement go beyond those of the environmentalism movement.

Environmental justice advocates contend that instances of environmental injustice are not simply arbitrary realities which occur in varying contexts.  Rather, instances of environmental injustice are the outcome of an institutional oppression and isolation which have set up an inevitable framework of the powerful oppressing the powerless. The victims, through a significant occurrence of historical and social realities, have been cut off from the power required even to challenge the causes of environmental injustice.  In a very real sense, the environmental justice movement represents another dimension of social liberation, which attempts to protect victims from institutional and systemic oppression. However, the task of the environmental justice movement should not be understood only in terms of the negative.  The central and positive question of the environmental justice movement is, “What constitutes healthy, livable, sustainable, and viable communities in the place we live, work, and play as the outcome of interrelated natural, built, social, and cultural/spiritual environments?” (Lee, 141-44).

The environmental justice movement also understands environmental injustice as part of a history of oppression and contends that profound historical realities predating the contemporary context of human existence in the Western world lie at the root of environmental injustice.  Advocates of environmental justice contend that the lack of power on the part of the victims of environmental injustice have a direct relationship of continuity with events emerging from the recent civil rights issues, to the civil war, and even trace the root cause of the systemic lack of power by certain groups to the impact of European-based realities which continue to shape the modern context of environmental injustice.  Environmental justice proponents focus upon what is termed “the four interlocking C’s” which have led to the exploitation of particular groups of people.  These “C’s” are conquest, colonization, commerce, and Christian implantation.

The call for environmental justice focuses on both environmental and ecological economics, which are reflected respectively in the work of environmental economics advocates such as Herman Daly, John Kenneth Galbraith and Nicholas Georgescu-Roegen, and ecological economics advocates such as Rebecca Pates and John Hagan.  While the environmental justice movement is primarily concerned with issues related to the United States, any consideration of the movement must acknowledge the contributions of these individuals and others and their work regarding global considerations since many of the issues with which the environmental justice movement is concerned are also contained within movements outside the United States dialogue and debate.

2. History of the Environmental Justice Movement

The environmental justice movement originated with the passing of the Civil Rights Act of 1964 and of Title VI, which prohibited the use of federal funds to discriminate on the basis of race, color and national origin.  The movement is also related to the work of Dr. Martin Luther King in the late 1960’s and his efforts on behalf of black sanitation workers in the city of Memphis, Tennessee.  In 1969, Ralph Abascal of the California Rural Legal Assistance filed a suit on behalf of six migrant farm workers, which resulted in the banning of the pesticide DDT. In addition, Congress passed the National Environmental Policy Act (NEPA) that same year.  In 1971, the President’s Council on Environmental Quality (CEQ) acknowledged racial discrimination which adversely affected urban poor and the quality of their environment.  In 1978, the Houston Northwood Manor subdivision residents protested the Whispering Pines Sanitary Landfill and in 1979 Linda McKeever Bullard filed a lawsuit on behalf of Houston’s Northeast Community Action Group. This lawsuit, titled Bean v. Southwestern Waste Management Inc, constituted the first civil rights suit challenging the siting of a waste facility.  The United Church of Christ Commission for Racial Justice issued the “Toxic Waste and Race in the United States” report in 1987.  The report was the first national study exposing the relationship between waste facility location and race.  The Clean Air Act was passed in 1990 and Bullard’s book Dumping in Dixie was published in the same year.  This particular work constituted the first textbook on environmental justice.  The first National People of Color Environmental Leadership Summit was held in Washington in 1991.  In 1994, The Environmental Justice Resource Center was formed at Clark Atlanta University in Atlanta, Georgia.  In addition, during the same year the Washington Office on Environmental Justice (WOEJ) opened in Washington D.C.  The United States environmental justice movement progressed onto the global stage in 1995 when environmental justice delegates participated in the 4th World Conference on Women in Beijing.

The environmental justice movement has existed for more than two decades, reaching an apex in the 1990’s. The movement emerged from an increased awareness of the disproportionately high impacts of environmental pollution on economically and politically disadvantaged communities. It addresses issues such as social, economic and political marginalization of minorities and low income populations, and is also concerned with the perceived increase of pollution not only in neighborhoods and communities, but also in the workplace.

There is no specific founding point for the environmental justice movement, but it was largely created through the fusion of two other movements — the economic analysis of the anti-toxics movement and the racial critique of the Civil Rights movement — and the over-arching perspective of a third — faith. Other strong contributions have come from  academia, from Native Americans, and the labor. (Timeline)

African Americans did not significantly challenge the environmental problems adversely affecting their communities prior to the call for environmental justice.  The shift from denial to acknowledgment and action emerged during the 1980’s.  Until that time African American resistance was largely limited to concern with local issues and generally was concerned with the individualistic nature of the African American struggle for equality.  However, in the 1980’s a transition took place which would give rise to the environmental justice movement as an extension of the Civil Rights movement.  This shift took place under the designation of “environmental activism” (DD, 29).

The environmental justice movement is credited with having begun in Warren County, North Carolina. In this locale residents demonstrated against a landfill which would be placed in their county. The reaction of the citizens concerning the issue reflected the merging of civil rights activists and environmentalists. Representatives from these two groups are alleged to have laid down in front of trucks transferring large amounts of PCB-contaminated soil into the largely African American populated area of Warren County. While the Warren County demonstrations were unsuccessful, they did achieve the result of bringing a renewed focus to the issue of the disproportionately high impact of environmental pollution upon minority communities such as Warren County. Ultimately, this event also placed environmental justice concerns onto the political agenda.

In 1992, a National Law Journal report alleged that the Environmental Protection Agency (EPA) had discriminated in its enforcement of environmental protection law thereby supporting the observations of those among whom the movement originally emerged.  The report indicated that federal fines were more lax for industries operating in communities of color. In addition, the report also contended that the cleanup of environmental disasters in communities of color were much slower than those carried out in the context of wealthier white communities.  Furthermore, the report indicated that standards for clean up in communities of color were not as well established or rigid as those applied in white communities.

3. Environmental Racism and Environmental Justice

Environmental justice advocates argue that an intimate relationship exists between the trilogy of environmental racism, environmental discrimination, and environmental policymaking.  Environmental injustice and environmental racism have their roots in a politico-institutional context bent toward discrimination.  Municipal, state, and federal regulations are, therefore, aimed at permitting, condoning and even promoting environmental racism.

In addition, environmental justice proponents contend that governmental policy is also bent toward the deliberate targeting of communities of color for toxic waste disposal and also the establishing of polluting industries in those communities. Further, policy and legislation not only permit but also endorse the official sanctioning of life-threatening poisons and pollutants being located in communities of color. Environmental justice advocates also contend that residents of victimized people groups are ostracized from access to political power and consequently have been excluded from service on decision-making boards and regulatory bodies, thereby subtly yet deliberately promoting environmental injustice and environmental racism.  Each of these elements contributes to the existence and propagation of environmental injustice and environmental racism (CER, 3).

Environmental justice proponents contend, “Experiences of environmental racism and injustice are not random, nor are they individual.” Consequently, the environmental justice movement is concerned with these two matters, collectivism and perceived intentionality.  On the one hand, environmental justice advocates concern themselves with environmental injustice as it happens to groups; and on the other hand, environmental justice advocates are also concerned with the systemic causes of environmental injustice (Rasmussen, 3-4).

Robert Bullard states that race is a major factor in predicting the placement of Locally Unwanted Land Uses (LULUs). Some would contend that socio-economic class is the central issue, however. Bullard counters that while race and class are combined factors, race is still the predominant factor. Environmental justice activists pronounce that race dominates policy decisions made by those in positions of power since the power arrangements of socio-economic institutions are out of balance.

Bullard also advances that environmental justice is not a social program, nor is it an affirmative action program and also that ultimately the central concern of the movement is the implementation of justice.  In addition, Bullard maintains that the consideration of race in the environmental justice movement, while constituting a portion of the problematic equation associated with environmental injustice is not the only concern of the movement.

We are just as much concerned with inequities in Appalachia, for example, where the whites are basically dumped on because of lack of economic and political clout and lack of having a voice to say ‘no’ and that’s environmental injustice.  We are trying to work with folks across the political spectrums; democrats, republicans, independents, on the reservations, in the barrios, in the ghettos, on the border and internationally to se what we address these issues in a comprehensive manner. (Interview)

However, in his earlier work entitled Confronting Environmental Racism: Voices from the Grassroots, Bullard does give voice to his belief that the problem of environmental injustice is to a large extent a racially oriented problem and that this is a problem which communities of color face.  He couches his discussion concerning environmental justice in the context of the recognition that at the heart of the problem of environmental injustice is a racially divided nation in which extreme racial inequalities persist.  However, by the time of Bullard’s more major work entitled Dumping in Dixie, he had acknowledged that the reality of environmental injustice transcends the issue of the victimization of any one race or ethnic group (CER, 7).

4. Principles of the Environmental Justice Movement

The result of the 1992 National Law Journal report concluded that the EPA had discriminated in its enforcement of Environmental Protection Law Report, which was intended to remedy the reality of environmental racism in the United States. Consequently, in 1991 at the First National People of Color Leadership Summit meeting in Washington D.C., the Principles of Environmental Justice were adopted.  These principles represent an initial rallying cry on behalf of those inhabitants, human and non-human, who are the victims of environmental injustice, and eventually established a context for a guide to action regarding governmental legislation.  Those principles are:

  1. Environmental justice affirms the sacredness of Mother Earth, ecological unity and the interdependence of all species, and the right to be free from ecological destruction.
  2. Environmental justice demands that public policy be based on mutual respect and justice for all peoples, free from any form of discrimination or bias.
  3. Environmental justice mandates the right to ethical, balanced and responsible uses of land and renewable resources in the interest of a sustainable planet for humans and other living things.
  4. Environmental justice calls for universal protection from nuclear testing, extraction, production and disposal of toxic/hazardous wastes and poisons and nuclear testing that threaten the fundamental right to clean air, land, water, and food.
  5. Environmental justice affirms the fundamental right to political, economic, cultural and environmental self-determination of all peoples.
  6. Environmental justice demands the cessation of the production of all toxins, hazardous wastes, and radioactive materials, and that all past and current producers be held strictly accountable to the people for detoxification and the containment at the point of production.
  7. Environmental justice demands the right to participate as equal partners at every level of decision-making including needs assessment, planning, implementation, enforcement and evaluation.
  8. Environmental justice affirms the right of all workers to a safe and healthy work environment, without being forced to choose between an unsafe livelihood and unemployment. It also affirms the right of those who work at home to be free from environmental hazards.
  9. Environmental justice protects the right of victims of environmental injustice to receive full compensation and reparations for damages as well as quality health care.
  10. Environmental justice considers governmental acts of environmental injustice a violation of international law, the Universal Declaration on Human Rights, and the United Nations Convention on Genocide.
  11. Environmental justice must recognize a special legal and natural relationship of Native Peoples to the U.S. government through treaties, agreements, compacts, and covenants affirming sovereignty and self-determination.
  12. Environmental justice affirms the need for urban and rural ecological policies to clean up and rebuild our cities and rural areas in balance with nature, honoring the cultural integrity of all our communities, and providing fair access for all to the full range of resources.
  13. Environmental justice calls for the strict enforcement of principles of informed consent, and a halt to the testing of experimental reproductive and medical procedures and vaccinations on people of color.
  14. Environmental justice opposes the destructive operations of multi-national corporations.
  15. Environmental justice opposes military occupation, repression and exploitation of lands, peoples and cultures, and other life forms.
  16. Environmental justice calls for the education of present and future generations, which emphasizes social and environmental issues, based on our experience and an appreciation of our diverse cultural perspectives.
  17. Environmental justice requires that we, as individuals, make personal and consumer choices to consume as little of Mother Earth’s resources and to produce as little waste as possible; and make the conscious decision to challenge and reprioritize our lifestyles to insure the health of the natural world for present and future generations (ejnet).

The First National People of Color Leadership Summit brought together hundreds of environmental justice activists representing both the national as well as the global stage.  The objective of the conference was to advocate for local and regional environmental justice activism in the form of both regional and ethnic networks. The Summit led to the creation of the Asian Pacific Environmental Network, the Northeast Environmental Justice Network, the Southern Organizing Committee for Economic and Environmental Justice and the Midwest/Great Lakes Environmental Justice Network. In 1993 Max Baucus, Democrat from Montana introduced the Environmental Justice Act of 1993 that addressed assertions that poor and minority areas are disproportionately affected by environmental pollution.  Representative John Lewis, Democrat from Georgia introduced a similar bill in the House of Representatives.

5. Causes of Environmental Injustice

Environmental injustice is said to exist when members of disadvantaged ethnic minority or other groups suffer disproportionately at the local, regional (subnational), or national levels from environmental risks or hazards or from violations of fundamental human rights as a result of environmental factors.  In addition, environmental injustice has occurred when an individual or group of individuals is denied access to environmental investments, benefits, and natural resources.  Furthermore, environmental injustice has taken place when individuals or collective groups are denied access to information, and/or participation in decision-making, as well as access to justice in environment-related matters. The study of environmental injustice has the responsibilities of examining the hierarchies of power that are inherent in any given socio-cultural context and the manner in which those hierarchies not only tolerate but also propagate environmental injustice against any number of disadvantaged people groups (EIPS, 2).

One cause of environmental injustice is institutionalized racism.  Institutionalized racism is defined as the practical reality of deliberately and intentionally targeting neighborhoods and communities comprised of a majority of people of low socio-economic status and of a collective group of individuals of color and is considered to be the natural outgrowth of racism. According to environmental justice proponents, this racism has become acculturated and engrained in contemporary social institutions, not the least of which is a governmental bureaucracy on the municipal, state, and federal levels which not only permits but reinforces the imposition of environmental injustice upon these groups.  Bunyan Bryant defines environmental racism as “the systematic exclusion of people of color from environmental decisions affecting their communities” (Bryant, 5 and Rasmussen, 8).

Another factor leading to the reality of environmental injustice is the commoditization of land, water, energy and air. This has resulted in their being secured and protected for the benefit of those in power over those who lack power.  Advocates of environmental justice remind that regardless of our status in life, we all exist collectively within the context of this biosphere.  Therefore “we breathe the same air, share the same atmosphere with the same ozone layer and climate patterns, eat food from the same soils and seas, and harvest the same acid rain” (Rasmussen, 8).

In addition, the unresponsive and unaccountable governmental policies and regulations which exist at all levels of government contribute to environmental racism and environmental injustice. Government authorities are frequently unresponsive to community needs regarding environmental inequities due to the existence of an oppressive power structure.  Furthermore, governmental availability to powerful corporations who exert power as an act of self-interest also poses problems.  Consequently, the victims of environmental injustice find it difficult if not impossible to use governmental resources and power to advance their cause (Rasmussen, 8).

Moreover, the lack of resources and power in affected communities is a major contributor to the presence of environmental racism.  In addition to the previous obstacles is the common denominator of powerlessness on the part of the victimized on the basis of few financial resources to invest in the struggle for environmental justice and also the lack of power by the victims of environmental injustice.  Specifically, the groups adversely affected by environmental inequities lack the capacity to function as an organized block representing their interests against those in the contest of authority and affluence (Rasmussen, 8).

Finally, a piecemeal approach to regulation which allows loopholes and the consequent ongoing victimization of low-income populations of color contributes to the reality of environmental racism.  The ongoing process of governmental regulation also poses a problem in combating environmental injustice and the implementation of environmental justice.  The consequent gaps between pieces of legislation which are passed in an effort to combat environmental injustice frequently provide a context for the skirting the intent of this legislation (Rasmussen, 8).

6. Major Events in the Environmental Justice Movement

A major event contributing to the development of the environmental movement in the United States was the National Environmental Policy Act of 1969 (NEPA).  The Act established a foundation for United States environmental policy and required that “any major federal action significantly affecting the quality of the human environment” requires evaluation and public disclosure of potential environmental impact through the required Environmental Impact Statement (EIS).  The EIS required by NEPA applies broadly to such categories as highways and other forms of transit projects and programs, natural resource leasing and extraction, industrial farming and policies governing genetically modified crops, as well as large scale urban development projects (NEPA 1969).  NEPA was signed into law on January 1, 1970. The Act establishes national environmental policy and goals for the protection, maintenance, and enhancement of the environment and it provides a process for implementing these goals within the federal agencies.

NEPA also established the Council on Environmental Quality (CEQ).  In its 1971 annual report, CEQ noted that populations of low-income people of color were disproportionately exposed to significant environmental hazards. This recognition constitutes the earliest governmental report acknowledging the existence of what may be termed environmental inequality in the United States.  In 1983 Robert Bullard published his groundbreaking case study of waste disposal practices in Houston, Texas entitled “Solid Waste Sites and the Black Houston Community.” The case study resulted in the publication of Bullard’s Dumping in Dixie: Race, Class, and Environmental Quality in1990. Bullard’s original study discovered that waste sites were not scattered on a random basis throughout the city of Houston, but that they were more likely to be located in African American neighborhoods and even more shockingly near schools.  Bullard’s work was the first actual study to examine the causes of environmental racism.  Bullard discovered a multiplicity of factors which led to the environmental inequality including housing discrimination, lack of zoning and racially and socio-economically insensitive decisions made by public officials over a period of fifty years.

In 1983, further documenting the realities of environmental discrimination, a congressionally authorized U.S. General Accounting Office study uncovered that three out of four off-site, commercial hazardous waste landfills in the southeastern United States were located within predominately African American communities. This was the reality despite the fact that African Americans made up only one-fifth of the region’s population. In 1990, sociologist Robert Bullard published his influential work entitled Dumping in Dixie.His was the first major study of environmental racism linking hazardous facility locations with historical patterns of segregation in the South. In addition, Bullard’s study was one of the first to explore the social and psychological impacts of environmental racism on local populations, as well as acknowledging the emerging environmental justice movement as a response from the communities against these increasingly documented environmental threats.

On February 11, 1994, President Bill Clinton signed Executive Order 12898, Federal Actions to Address Environmental Justice in Minority Populations and Low-Income Populations, to focus federal attention on the environmental and human health conditions of minority and low-income populations with the goal of achieving environmental protection for all communities. The Order directed federal agencies to develop environmental justice strategies to help federal agencies address disproportionately high and adverse human health or environmental effects of their programs on minority and low-income populations. The order is also intended to promote nondiscrimination in federal programs that affect human health and the environment. It aims to provide minority and low-income communities with access to public information and public participation in matters relating to human health and the environment. The Presidential Memorandum accompanying the Order underscores certain provisions of existing law that can help ensure that all communities and persons across the nation live in a safe and healthy environment. Also in 1994, The Environmental Protection Agency renamed the Office of Environmental Equity as the Office of Environmental Justice. The Environmental Justice Act of 1999 introduced into the U.S. Legislature was also a sign of significant progress. In 2003 the EPA established the environmental justice bibliographic database.

7. Environmental Justice Policy and Law

The environmental justice movement credits its momentum and effectiveness to the U.S. Constitution and three significant pieces of legislation: Title VI 601; 602; and 42 U.S.C. 1983.

The Fourteenth Amendment and Equal Protection

Prior to the establishing of terms such as “environmental justice” or environmental racism”, residents living in minority communities who believed they were the victims of unfair environmental policy brought fourteenth amendment actions before local municipalities seeking fair treatment. In Dowdell v. City of Apopka, 1983, discrimination in street paving, water distribution, and storm draining services was established. In United Farm Workers of Florida v. City of Delray Beach, 1974 it was established that there were violations of farm workers’ civil rights by city officials. In Johnson v. City of Arcadia, 1978 the court found discrimination in access to paved streets, parks, and the water supply.  The Supreme Court’s decision in Washington v. Davis, 1976 announced the rule that impermissible discrimination under the Fourteenth Amendment requires a showing of intent, not simply of disparate impact.  In Village of Arlington Heights v. Metropolitan Housing Development Co., 1977 the Court established a set of factors to determine whether invidious discrimination underlies an otherwise legitimate exercise of government authority.

Title VI, Civil Rights Act 601, 602, and 42 U.S.C. 198

Title VI, Civil Rights Act 601 states, “no person in the United States shall on the grounds of race, color or national origin be excluded from participation in, be denied the benefits of, or be subjected to discrimination under any program or activity receiving federal financial assistance.” (U.S.C. 1994) Title VI, Civil rights Act 602 requires “agencies that disperse federal funds to promulgate regulations implementing Title VI Civil rights Act and to create an enforcement framework that details the manner in which discrimination claims will be processed” (Shanahan, 403-406).

In addition to the two foregoing Acts, environmental justice advocates also use 42 U.S.C. 1983 in order to establish that the effect of the agencies’ decision will have a negative impact on the community.  42 U.S.C. 1983 states:

Every person who, under color of any statute, ordinance, regulation, custom, or usage, of any State or Territory or the District of Columbia, subjects, or causes to be subjected, any citizen of the United States or other person within the jurisdiction thereof to the deprivation of any rights, privileges, or immunities secured by the Constitution and laws, shall be liable to the party injured in an action at law (U.S.C. 1983).

These pieces of legislation were beneficial to the environmental justice movement until 2001 when the Supreme Court, in Alexander v. Sandoval held that “602 does not provide an implied private right of action to enforce disparate impact regulations promoted by federal agencies pursuant to 602.”

8. References and Further Reading

a. Books

  • Bullard Robert, Dumping in Dixie: Race, Class, and Environmental Quality. Westview Press, 2000. (cited as DD)
  • Bullard, Robert, Confronting Environmental Racism: Voices from the Grassroots. South End Press, 1993. (cited as CER)
  • Bryant, Bunyan, ed. Environmental Justice: Issues, Problems, and Solutions. Island Press, 1995. (cited as EJ)
  • Camacho, David E. Environmental Injustices, Political Struggles: Race, Class, and the Environment. Duke University Press, 1988.  (cited as EIPS)
  • Rawls, John, Theory of Justice 2nd Edition Oxford University Press, 1999. (cited as TJ)
  • Rawls, Justice as Fairness: A Re-statement. Belknap Press, 2001. (cited as JF)

b. Journals

  • Environmental Justice: An Interview with Robert Bullard, Earth First Journal, July 1999. (cited as Interview)
  • Drummond, Celia Deane, “Environmental Justice and the Economy: A Christian Theologians Views” Ecotheology 11.3 2006: 24-34 (Deane Drummond)
  • Lee, Charles, “environmental justice: Building a Unified Vision of Health and the Environment” Environmental Health Perspectives 10, Supplement 2 (April 2002), 141-144.
  • Rasmussen, Larry, “Environmental Racism and environmental justice: Moral Theory in the Making? Journal of the Society of Christian Ethics 24 1 (2004): 11-28. (cited as Rasmussen)
  • Shanahan, Alice M. “Permitting Justice: EPA’s Revised Guidance for Investigating Title VI Administrative Complaints. ENVTL. LAWYER 403, 406 (Feb. 2001) (citing the Civil Rights Act of 1964, §602, 78 Stat. at 252-253). (cited as Shanahan)

c. Governmental and Legal Publications

  • 42 U.S.C. § 1983 (2002). (cited as U.S.C. 1983)
  • 42 U.S.C. § 2000 (d) (1994). (cited as U.S.C. 1994)
  • Alexander v. Sandoval 532 U.S. 275 (cited as Alexander)

Author Information

Eddy F. Carder
Email: efcarder@pvamu.edu
Prairie View A & M University
U. S. A.

Jerry A. Fodor (1935—2017)

J. FodorJerry Fodor was one of the most important philosophers of mind of the late twentieth and early twenty-first centuries. In addition to exerting an enormous influence on virtually all parts of the literature in the philosophy of mind since 1960, Fodor’s work had a significant impact on the development of the cognitive sciences. In the 1960s, along with Hilary Putnam, Noam Chomsky, and others, Fodor presented influential criticisms of the behaviorism that dominated much philosophy and psychology at the time. Fodor went on to articulate and defend an alternative conception of intentional states and their content that he argues vindicates the core elements of folk psychology within a physicalist framework.

Fodor developed two theories that have been particularly influential across disciplinary boundaries. He defended a “Representational Theory of Mind,” according to which thinking is a computational process defined over mental representations that are physically realized in the brain. On Fodor’s view, these mental representations are internally structured much like sentences in a natural language, in that they have both a syntax and a compositional semantics. Fodor also defends an influential hypothesis about mental architecture, namely, that low-level sensory systems (and language) are “modular,” in the sense that they’re “informationally encapsulated” from the higher-level “central” systems responsible for belief formation, decision-making, and the like. Fodor’s work on modularity has been especially influential among evolutionary psychologists, who go much further than Fodor in claiming that the systems underlying even high-level cognition are modular, a view that Fodor himself vehemently resists.

Fodor has defended a number of other well-known views. He was an early proponent of the claim that mental states are functional states, defined by their role in a cognitive system and not by the physical material that constitutes them. Alongside functionalism, Fodor articulated an early and influential version of non-reductive physicalism, according to which mental states are realized by, but not reducible to, physical states of the brain. Fodor was also a staunch defender of nativism about the structure and contents of the human mind, arguing against a variety of empiricist theories and famously arguing that all lexical concepts are innate. Fodor vigorously argued against all versions of conceptual role semantics in philosophy and psychology, and articulated an alternative view he calls “informational atomism,” according to which lexical concepts are unstructured “atoms” that have their content in virtue of standing in certain external, “informational” relations to entities in the environment.

Table of Contents

  1. Biography
  2. Physicalism, Functionalism, and the Special
    Sciences
  3. Intentional Realism
  4. The Representational Theory of Mind
  5. Content and Concepts
  6. Nativism
  7. Modularity
  8. References and Further Reading

1. Biography

Jerry Fodor was born in New York City on April 22, 1935. He received his A.B. degree from Columbia University in 1956 and his Ph.D. from Princeton University in 1960. His first academic position was at MIT, where he taught in the Departments of Philosophy and Psychology until 1986. He was Distinguished Professor at CUNY Graduate Center from 1986 to 1988, when he moved to Rutgers University, where he was State of New Jersey Professor of Philosophy and Cognitive Science until his retirement in 2016. Fodor died on November 29, 2017.

2. Physicalism, Functionalism, and the
Special Sciences

Throughout his career Fodor endorsed physicalism, the claim that all the genuine particulars and properties in the world are either identical to or in some sense determined by and dependent upon physical particulars and properties. Although there are contested questions about how physicalism should be formulated and understood (Melnyk 2003, Stoljar 2010), there is nevertheless widespread acceptance of some or other version of physicalism among philosophers of mind. To accept physicalism is to deny that psychological and other non-basic properties of the world “float free” from fundamental physical properties. Accepting physicalism thus goes hand in hand with rejecting mind-body dualism.

Some of Fodor’s early work (1968, 1975) aimed (i) to show that “mentalism” was a genuine alternative to dualism and behaviorism, (ii) to show that behaviorism had a number of serious shortcomings, (iii) to defend functionalism as the appropriate physicalist metaphysics underlying mentalism, and (iv) to defend a conception of psychology and other special sciences according to which higher-level laws and the properties that figure in them are irreducible to lower-level laws and properties. Let’s consider each of these in turn.

For much of the twentieth century, behaviorism was widely regarded as the only viable physicalist alternative to dualism. Fodor helped to change that, in part by drawing a clear distinction between mere mentalism, which posits the existence of internal, causally efficacious mental states, and dualism, which is mentalism plus the view that mental states are states of a non-physical substance. Here’s Fodor in his classic book Psychological Explanation:

[P]hilosophers who have wanted to banish the ghost from the machine have usually sought to do so by showing that truths about behavior can sometimes, and in some sense, logically implicate truths about mental states. In so doing, they have rather strongly suggested that the exorcism can be carried through only if such a logical connection can be made out. … [O]nce it has been made clear that the choice between dualism and behaviorism is not exhaustive, a major motivation for the defense of behaviorism is removed: we are not required to be behaviorists simply in order to avoid being dualists (1968, pp. 58-59).

Fodor thus argues that there’s a middle road between dualism and behaviorism. Attributing mental states to organisms in explaining how they get around in and manipulate their environments need not involve the postulation of a mental substance different in kind from physical bodies and brains. In Fodor’s view, behaviorists influenced by Wittgenstein and Ryle ignored the distinction between mentalism and dualism. As Fodor puts it, “confusing mentalism with dualism is the original sin of the Wittgensteinian tradition” (1975, p. 4).

In addition to clearly distinguishing mentalism from dualism, Fodor put forward a number of trenchant objections to behaviorism and the various arguments for it. He argued that neither knowing about the mental states of others nor learning a language with mental terms requires that there be a logical connection between mental and behavioral terms, thus undermining a number of epistemological and linguistic arguments for behaviorism (Fodor and Chihara 1965, Fodor 1968). Perhaps more importantly, Fodor argued that empirical theories in cognitive psychology and linguistics provide a powerful argument against behaviorism, since they posit the existence of various mental states that are not definable in terms of overt behavior (Fodor 1968, 1975). Along with the arguments of Putnam (1963, 1967) and Chomsky (1959), among others, Fodor’s early arguments against behaviorism were an important step in the development of the then emerging cognitive sciences.

Central to this development was the rise of functionalism as a genuine alternative to behaviorism, and Fodor’s Psychological Explanation (1968) was one of the first in-depth treatments and defenses of this view (see also Putnam 1963, 1967). Unlike behaviorism, which attempts to explain behavior in terms of law-like relationships between stimulus inputs and behavioral outputs, functionalism explains behavior in terms of internal properties that mediate between inputs and outputs. Indeed, the main claim of functionalism is that mental properties are individuated in terms of the various causal relations they enter into, where such relations are not restricted to mere input-output relations, but also include their relations to a host of other properties that figure in the relevant empirical theories. Although, at the time, the distinctions between various forms of functionalism weren’t as clear as they are now, Fodor’s brand of functionalism is a version of what is now known as “psycho-functionalism”. On this view, the causal roles that define mental properties are provided by empirical psychology, and not, say, the platitudes of commonsense psychology, or the analyticities expressive of the meanings of mental terms; see Rey (1997, ch.7) and Shoemaker (2003) for discussion.

By defining mental properties in terms of their causal roles, functionalists allow that the same mental property can be instantiated by different kinds of physical systems. Functionalism thus goes hand in hand with the multiple realizability of mental properties. If a given mental property, M, is a functional property that’s defined by a specific causal condition, C, then any number of distinct physical properties, P1, P2, P3… Pn, may each “realize” M in virtue of meeting condition C. Functionalism thereby characterizes mental properties at a level of abstraction that ignores differences in the physical structure of the systems that have these properties. Early functionalists, like Fodor and Putnam, thus took themselves to be articulating a position that was distinct not only from behaviorism, but also from type-identity theory, which identifies mental properties with neurophysiological properties of the brain. If functionalism implies that mental properties can be realized by different physical properties in different kinds of systems (or the same system over time), then functionalism apparently precludes identifying mental properties with physical properties.

Fodor, in particular, articulated his functionalism so that it was seen to have sweeping consequences for debates concerning reductionism and the unity of science. In his seminal essay “Special Sciences” (1974), and also in the introductory chapter of his classic book The Language of Thought (1975), Fodor spells out a metaphysical picture of the special sciences that eventually came to be called “non-reductive physicalism”. This picture is physicalist in that it accepts what Fodor calls the “generality of physics,” which is the claim that every event that falls under a special science predicate also falls under a physical predicate, but not vice versa. It’s non-reductionist in that it denies that “the special sciences should reduce to physical theories in the long run” (1974, p. 97). Traditionally, reductionists sought to articulate bridge laws that link special science predicates with physical predicates, either in the form of bi-conditionals or identity statements. Fodor argues not only that the generality of physics does not require the existence of bridge laws, but that such laws will in general be unavailable given that the events picked out by special science predicates will be “wildly disjunctive” from the perspective of physics (1974, p. 103). Multiple realizability thus guarantees that special science predicates will cross-classify phenomena picked out by physical predicates. This, in turn, undermines the reductionist hope of a unified science whereby the higher-level theories of the special sciences reduce to lower-level theories and ultimately to fundamental physics. On Fodor’s picture, then, the special sciences are “autonomous” in that they articulate irreducible generalizations that quantify over irreducible and casually efficacious higher-level properties (1974, 1975; see also 1998b, ch.2).

Functionalism and non-reductive physicalism are now commonplace in philosophy of mind, and provide the backdrop for many contemporary debates about psychological explanation, laws, multiple realizability, mental causation, and more. This is something for which Fodor surely deserves much of the credit (or blame, depending on one’s view; see Kim 2005 and Heil 2003 for criticisms of the metaphysical underpinnings of non-reductive physicalism).

3. Intentional Realism

A central aim of Fodor’s work is to defend the core elements of folk psychology as at least the starting point for a serious scientific psychology. At a minimum, folk psychology is committed to two kinds of states: belief-like states, which represent the world and guide one’s behavior, and desire-like states, which represent one’s goals and motivate behavior. We routinely appeal to such states in our common-sense explanations of people’s behavior.  For example, we explain why John went to the store in terms of his desire for milk and his belief that there’s milk for sale at the store. Fodor is impressed by the remarkable predictive power of such belief-desire explanations. The following passage is typical:

Common sense psychology works so well it disappears. It’s like those mythical Rolls Royce cars whose engines are sealed when they leave the factory; only it’s better because they aren’t mythical. Someone I don’t know phones me at my office in New York from—as it might be—Arizona. ‘Would you like to lecture here next Tuesday?’ are the words he utters. ‘Yes thank you. I’ll be at your airport on the 3 p.m. flight’ are the words that I reply. That’s all that happens, but it’s more than enough; the rest of the burden of predicting behavior—of bridging the gap between utterances and actions—is routinely taken up by the theory. And the theory works so well that several days later (or weeks later, or months later, or years later; you can vary the example to taste) and several thousand miles away, there I am at the airport and there he is to meet me. Or if I don’t turn up, it’s less likely that the theory failed than that something went wrong with the airline. … The theory from which we get this extraordinary predictive power is just good old common sense belief/desire psychology. … If we could do that well with predicting the weather, no one would ever get his feet wet; and yet the etiology of the weather must surely be child’s play compared with the causes of behavior. (1987, pp. 3-4)

Passages like this may suggest that Fodor’s intentional realism is wedded to the folk-psychological categories of “belief” and “desire”. But this isn’t so. Rather, Fodor’s claim is that there are certain core elements of folk psychology that will be shared by a mature scientific psychology. In particular, Fodor’s view is that a mature psychology will posit states with the following features:@

(1) They will be intentional: they will be “about” things and they will be semantically evaluable. (John’s belief that there’s milk at the store is about the milk at the store, and can be semantically evaluated as true or false.)

(2) They will be causal: they will figure in genuine causal explanations and laws. (John’s belief that there’s milk at the store and his desire for milk figure in a law-like causal explanation of John’s behavior.)

Fodor’s intentional realism thus doesn’t require that folk-psychological categories themselves find a place in a mature psychology. Indeed, Fodor has suggested that the individuation conditions for beliefs are “so vague and pragmatic” that they may not be fit for empirical psychology (1990, p. 175). What Fodor is committed to is the claim that a mature psychology will be intentional through and through, and that the intentional states it posits will be causally implicated in law-like explanations of human behavior. Exactly which intentional states will figure in a mature psychology is a matter to be decided by empirical inquiry, not by a priori reflection on our common sense understanding.

Fodor’s defense of intentional realism is usefully viewed as part of a rationalist tradition that stresses the human mind’s striking ability to think about indefinitely many arbitrary properties of the world. Our minds are apparently sensitive not only to abstract properties such as being a democracy and being virtuous, but also to abstract grammatical properties such as being a noun phrase and being a verb phrase, as well as to such arbitrary properties as being a tiny folded piece of paper, being an oddly-shaped canteen, being a crumpled shirt, and being to the left of my favorite mug. On Fodor’s (1986) view, a system can selectively respond to such non-sensory properties (or properties that are not “transducer detectable”) only if it’s an intentional system capable of manipulating representations of these properties. More specifically, Fodor claims that the distinguishing feature of intentional systems is that they’re sensitive to “non-nomic” properties, that is, properties of objects that do not determine that they fall under laws of nature. Consider Fodor’s (1986) example being a crumpled shirt. Although laws of nature govern crumpled shirts, no object is subsumed under a law in virtue of being a crumpled shirt. Nevertheless, the property of being a crumpled shirt is one that we can represent an object as having, and such representations do enter into laws. For instance, there’s presumably a law-like relationship between my noticing the crumpled shirt, my desire to remark upon it, and my saying “there’s a crumpled shirt”. On Fodor’s view, the job of intentional psychology is to articulate laws governing mental representations that figure in genuine causal explanations of people’s behavior (Fodor 1987, 1998a).

Although positing mental representations that have semantic and causal properties—states that satisfy (1) and (2) above—may not seem particularly controversial, the existence of causally efficacious intentional states has been denied by all manner of behaviorists, epiphenomenalists, Wittgensteinians, interpretationists, instrumentalists, and (at least some) connectionists. Much of Fodor’s work is devoted to defending intentional realism against such views as they have arisen in both philosophy and psychology. In addition to defending intentional realism against the behaviorism of Skinner and Ryle (Fodor 1968, 1975, Fodor et al. 1974), Fodor defends it against the threat of epiphenomenalism (Fodor 1989), against Wittgenstein and other defenders of the “private language argument” (Fodor and Chihara 1965, Fodor 1975), against the eliminativism of the Churchlands (Fodor 1987, 1990), against the instrumentalism of Dennett (Fodor 1981a, Fodor and Lepore 1992), against the interpretationism of Davidson (Fodor 1990, Fodor and Lepore 1992, Fodor 2004), and against certain versions of connectionism (Fodor and Pylyshyn 1988, Fodor 1998b, chs. 9 and 10).

4. The Representational Theory of Mind

For physicalists, accepting that there are mental states that are both intentional and causal raises the question of how such states can exist in a physical world. Intentional realists must explain, for instance, how lawful relations between intentional states can be understood physicalistically. Of particular concern is the fact that at least some intentional laws describe rational relations between the states they quantify over, and, at least since Descartes, philosophers have worried about how a purely physical system could be rational (see Lowe 2008 for skepticism from a non-Cartesian dualist). Fodor’s Representational Theory of Mind (RTM) is his attempt to answer such worries.

As Fodor points out, RTM is “really a loose confederation of theses” that “lacks, to put it mildly, a canonical formulation” (1998a, p. 6). At its core, though, RTM is an attempt to combine Alan Turing’s work on computation with intentional realism (as outlined above). Broadly speaking, RTM claims that mental processes are computational processes, and that intentional states are relations to mental representations that serve as the domain of such processes. On Fodor’s version of RTM, these mental representations have both syntactic structure and a compositional semantics. Thinking thus takes place in an internal language of thought.

Turing demonstrated how to construct a purely mechanical device that could transform syntacticallyindividuated symbols in a way that respects the semantic relations that exist between the meanings, or contents, of the symbols. Formally valid inferences are the paradigm. For instance, modus ponens can be realized on a machine that’s sensitive only to syntactic properties of symbols. The device thus doesn’t have “access” to the symbols’ semantic properties, but can nevertheless transform the symbols in a truth-preserving way. What’s interesting about this, from Fodor’s perspective, is that mental processes also involve chains of thoughts that are truth-preserving. As Fodor puts it:

[I]f you start out with a true thought, and you proceed to do some thinking, it is very often the case that the thoughts that thinking leads you to will also be true. This is, in my view, the most important fact we know about minds; no doubt it’s why God bothered to give us any. (1994, p. 9)

In order to account for this “most important” fact, RTM claims that thoughts themselves are syntactically-structured representations, and that mental processes are computational processes defined over them. Given that the syntax of a representation is what determines its causal role in thought, RTM thereby serves to connect the fact that mental processes are truth-preserving with the fact that they’re causal. On Fodor’s view, “this bringing of logic and logical syntax together with a theory of mental processes is the foundation of our cognitive science” (2008, p. 21).

Suppose a thinker believes that if John ran, then Mary swam. According to RTM, for a thinker to hold such a belief is for the thinker to stand in a certain computational relation to a mental representation that means if John ran, then Mary swam. Now suppose the thinker comes to believe that John ran, and as a result comes to believe that Mary swam. RTM has it that the causal relations between these thoughts hold in virtue of the syntactic form of the underlying mental representations. By picturing the mind as a “syntax-driven machine” (Fodor, 1987, p. 20), RTM thus promises to explain how the causal relations among thoughts can respect rational relations among their contents. It thereby provides a potentially promising reply to Descartes’ worry about how rationality could be exhibited by a mere machine. As Fodor puts it:

So we can now (maybe) explain how thinking could be both rational and mechanical. Thinking can be rational because syntactically specified operations can be truth preserving insofar as they reconstruct relations of logical form; thinking can be mechanical because Turing machines are machines. … [T]his really is a lovely idea and we should pause for a moment to admire it. Rationality is a normative property; that is, it’s one that a mental process ought to have. This is the first time that there has ever been a remotely plausible mechanical theory of the causal powers of a normative property. The first time ever. (2000, p. 19)

In Fodor’s view, it’s a major argument in favor of RTM that it promises an explanation of how mental processes can be truth-preserving, and a major strike against traditional empiricist and associationist theories that, in his view, they offer no plausible competing explanation (2000, pp. 15-18; 2003, pp. 90-94; Fodor and Pylyshyn 1998). (Note that Fodor does not think that RTM offers a satisfying explanation of all aspects of human rationality, as discussed below in the section on modularity.)

In addition to explaining how truth-preserving mental processes could be realized causally, Fodor argues, RTM provides the only hope of explaining the so-called “productivity” and “systematicity” of thought (Fodor 1987, 1998a, 2008). Roughly, productivity is the feature of our minds whereby there is no upper bound to the number of thoughts we can entertain. We can think that the dog is on the deck; that the dog, which chased the squirrel, is on the deck; that the dog, which chased the squirrel, which foraged for nuts, is on the deck; and so on, indefinitely.

Of course, there are thoughts whose contents are so long or complex that other factors prevent us from entertaining them. But abstracting away from such performance limitations, it seems that a theory of our conceptual competence must account for such productivity. Thought also appears to be systematic, in the following sense: a mind that is capable of entertaining a certain thought, p, is also capable of entertaining logical permutations of p. For example, minds that can entertain the thought that the book is to the left of the cup can also entertain the thought that the cup is to the left of the book. Although it’s perhaps possible that there could be minds that do not exhibit such systematicity—a possibility denied by some, for example, Evans (1982) and Peacocke (1992)—it at least appears to be an empirical fact that all minds do.

In Fodor’s view, RTM is the only theory of mind that can explain productivity and systematicity. According to RTM, mental states have internal, constituent structure, and the content of mental states is determined by the content of their constituents and how those constituents are put together. Given a finite base of primitive representations, our capacity to entertain endlessly many thoughts can be explained by positing a finite number of rules for combining representations, which can be applied endlessly many times in the course of constructing complex thoughts. RTM offers a similar explanation of systematicity. The reason that a mind that can entertain the thought that the book is to the left of the cup can also entertain the thought that the cup is to the left of the book is that these thoughts are built up out of the same constituents, using the same rules of combination. RTM thus explains productivity and systematicity because it claims that mental states are representations that have syntactic structure and a compositional semantics. One of Fodor’s main arguments against alternative, connectionist theories is that they fail to account for such features (Fodor and Pylyshyn 1988, Fodor 1998b, chs. 9 and 10).

A further argument Fodor offers in favor of RTM is that successful empirical theories of various non-demonstrative inferences presuppose a system of internal representations in which such inferences are carried out. For instance, standard theories of visual perception attempt to explain how a percept is constructed on the basis of the physical information available and the visual system’s built-in assumptions about the environment, or “natural constraints” (Pylyshyn 2003). Similarly, theories of sentence perception and comprehension require that the language system be able to represent distinct properties (for instance, acoustic, phonological, and syntactic properties) of a single utterance (Fodor et al. 1974). Both sorts of theories require that there be a system of representations capable of representing various properties and serving as the medium in which such inferences are carried out. Indeed, Fodor claims that the best argument in favor of RTM is that “some version or other of RTM underlies practically all current psychological research on mentation, and our best science is ipso facto our best estimate of what there is and what it’s made of” (Fodor 1987, p. 17). Fodor’s The Language of Thought (1975) is the locus classicus of this style of argument.

5. Content and Concepts

Suppose, as RTM suggests, that mental processes are computational processes, and that this explains how rational relations between thoughts can be realized by purely casual relations among symbols in the brain. This leaves open the question of how such symbols come to have their meaning, or content. At least since Brentano, philosophers have worried about how to integrate intentionality into the physical world, a worry that has famously led some to accept the “baselessness of intentional idioms and the emptiness of a science of intention” (Quine 1960, p. 221). Much of Fodor’s work from the 1980s onward was focused on this representational (as opposed to the computational) component of RTM. Although Fodor’s views changed in various ways over the years, some of which are documented below, a unifying theme throughout this work is that it’s at least possible to provide a naturalistic account of intentionality (Fodor 1987, 1990, 1991, 1994, 1998a, 2004, 2008; Fodor and Lepore 1992, 2002; Fodor and Pylyshyn 2014).

In the 1960s and early 1970s, Fodor endorsed a version of so-called “conceptual role semantics” (CRS), according to which the content of a representation is (partially) determined by the conceptual connections it bears to other representations. To take two hoary examples, CRS has it that “bachelor” gets its meaning, in part, by bearing an inferential connection to “unmarried,” and “kill” gets its meaning, in part, by bearing an inferential connection to “die”. Such inferential connections hold, on Fodor’s early view, because “bachelor” and “kill” have complex structure at the level at which they’re semantically interpreted—that is, they have the structure exhibited by the phrases “unmarried adult male” and “cause to die” (Katz and Fodor 1963). In terms of concepts, the claim is that the concept BACHELOR has the internal structure exhibited by ‘UNMARRIED ADULT MALE’, and the concept KILL has the internal structure exhibited by ‘CAUSE TO DIE’. (This article follows the convention of writing the names of concepts in capitals.)

However, Fodor soon came to think that there are serious objections to CRS. Some of these objections were based on his own experimental work in psycholinguistics, which he took to provide evidence against the existence of complex lexical structure. In particular, experimental evidence suggested that understanding a sentence does not involve recovering the (putative) decompositions of the lexical items it contains (Fodor et al. 1975, Fodor et al. 1980). For example, if “bachelor” has the semantic structure exhibited by “unmarried adult male,” then there is an implicit negation in the sentence “If practically all the men in the room are bachelors, then few men in the room have spouses.” But the evidence suggested that it’s easier to understand that sentence than similar sentences containing either an explicit negative (“not married”) or a morphological negative (“unmarried”), as in “If practically all the men in the room are not married/unmarried, then few men in the room have spouses”. This shouldn’t be the case, Fodor reasoned, if “bachelor” includes the negation at the level at which it is semantically interpreted (Fodor et al. 1975, Fodor et al. 1980). (For alternative explanations see Jackendoff (1983, pp. 125-127; 1992, p. 49; 2002, ch. 11), Katz (1977, 1981) and Miller and Johnson-Laird (1976, p. 328).)

In part because of the evidence against decompositional structure, Fodor at one point seriously considered the view that inferential connections among lexical items hold in virtue of inference rules, or “meaning postulates,” which renders CRS consistent with a denial of the claim that lexical items are semantically structured (1975, pp. 148-152). However, Fodor ultimately became convinced that Quine’s doctrine of “confirmation holism” undermines the appeal to meaning postulates, and more generally, any view that implies a principled distinction between those conceptual connections that are “constitutive” of a concept and those that are “merely collateral”. According to confirmation holism, our beliefs don’t have implications for experience when taken in isolation. As Quine famously puts it, “our statements about the external world face the tribunal of sense experience not individually but only as a corporate body” (1953, p. 41). This implies that disconfirming a belief is never simply a matter of testing it against experience. For one could continue to hold a belief in the face of recalcitrant data by revising other beliefs that form part of one’s overall theory. As Quine says, “any statement can be held true come what may, if we make drastic enough adjustments elsewhere in the system” (1953, p. 43). Such Quinean considerations motivate Fodor’s claim that CRS theorists should not appeal to meaning postulates:

Exactly because meaning postulates break the ‘formal’ relation between belonging to the structure of a concept and being among its constitutive inferences, it’s unclear why it matters … whether a given inference is treated as meaning-constitutive. Imagine two minds that differ in that ‘whale → mammal’ is a meaning postulate for one but is ‘general knowledge’ for the other. Are any further differences between these minds entailed? If so, which ones? Is this wheel attached to anything at all? It’s a point that Quine made against Carnap that the answer to ‘When is an inference analytic?’ can’t be just ‘Whenever I feel like saying that it is’. (1998a, p. 111)

Moreover, confirmation holism suggests that the epistemic properties of a concept are potentially connected to the epistemic properties of every other concept, which, according to Fodor, suggests that CRS inevitably leads to semantic holism, the claim that all of a concept’s inferential connections are constitutive. But Fodor argues that semantic holism is unacceptable, since it’s incompatible with the claim that concepts are shareable: “since practically everybody has some eccentric beliefs about practically everything, holism has it that nobody shares any concepts with anybody else” (2004, p. 35; see also Fodor and Lepore 1992, Fodor 1998a). This implication would undermine the possibility of genuine intentional generalizations, which require that type-identical contents are shared across both individuals and different time-slices of the same individual. (Fodor rejects appeals to a weaker notion of “content similarity”; see Fodor and Lepore 1992, pp. 17-22; Fodor 1998a, pp. 28-34.)

Proponents of CRS might reply to these concerns about semantic holism by accepting the ‘molecularist’ claim that only some inferential connections are concept-constitutive. But Fodor suggests that the only way to distinguish the constitutive connections from the rest is to endorse an analytic/synthetic distinction, which, again, confirmation holism gives us reason to reject (for example, 1990, p. x, 1998a, p. 71, 1998b, pp. 32-33, 2008). Fodor’s Quinean point, ultimately, is that theorists should be reluctant to claim that there are certain beliefs people must hold, or inferences they must accept, in order to possess a concept. For thinkers can apparently have any number of arbitrarily strange beliefs involving some concept, consistent with them sharing that concept with others. As Fodor puts it:

[P]eople can have radically false theories and really crazy views, consonant with our understanding perfectly well, thank you, which false views they have and what radically crazy things it is that they believe. Berkeley thought that chairs are mental, for Heaven’s sake! Which are we to say he lacked, the concept MENTAL or the concept CHAIR? (1987, p. 125) (For further reflections along similar lines, see Williamson 2007.)

On Fodor’s view, proponents of CRS are faced with two equally unsatisfying options: they can agree with Quine about the analytic/synthetic distinction, but at the cost of endorsing semantic holism and its unpalatable consequences for the viability of intentionality psychology; or they can deny holism and accept molecularism but at the cost of endorsing an analytic/synthetic distinction, which Fodor thinks nobody knows how to draw.

It bears emphasis that Fodor doesn’t claim that confirmation holism, all by itself, rules out the existence of certain “local” semantic connections that hold as a matter of empirical fact. Indeed, contemporary discussions of possible explanatory roles for analyticity involve delicate psychological and linguistic considerations that are far removed from the epistemological considerations that motivated the positivists. For instance, there are the standard convergences in people’s semantic-cum-conceptual intuitions, which cry out for an empirical explanation. Although some argue that such convergences are best explained by positing analyticities (Grice and Strawson 1956, Rey 2005, Rives 2016), Fodor argues that all such intuitions can be accounted for by an appeal to Quinean “centrality” or “one-criterion” concepts (Fodor 1998a, pp. 80-86). Considerations in linguistics that bear on the existence of an empirically grounded analytic/synthetic distinction include the syntactic and semantic analyses of ‘causative’ verbs, the ‘generativity’ of the lexicon, and the acquisition of certain elements of syntax. Fodor has engaged linguists on a number of such fronts, arguing against proposals of Jackendoff (1992), Pustejovsky (1995), Pinker (1989), Hale and Keyser (1993), and others, defending the Quinean line (see Fodor 1998a, pp. 49-56, and Fodor and Lepore 2002, chs. 5-6; see Pustejovsky 1998 and Hale and Keyser 1999 for rejoinders). Fodor’s view is that all of the relevant empirical facts about minds and language can be explained without any analytic connections, but merely deeply believed ones, precisely as Quine argued.

On Fodor’s view, the problems plaguing CRS ultimately arise as a result of its attempt to connect a theory of meaning with certain epistemic conditions of thinkers. A further argument against such views, Fodor claims, is that such epistemic conditions violate the compositionality constraint that is required for an explanation of productivity and systematicity (see above). For instance, if one believes that brown cows are dangerous, then the concept BROWN COW will license the inference ‘BROWN COW → DANGEROUS’; but this inference is not determined by the inferential roles of BROWN and COW, which it ought to be if meaning-constituting inferences are compositional (Fodor and Lepore 2002, ch.1; for discussion and criticism, see, for example, Block 1993, Boghossian 1993, and Rey 1993).

Another epistemic approach, favored by many psychologists, takes concepts to have “prototype” structure. According to these theories, the structure of a lexical concept specifies the prototypical features of its instances, that is, the features that its instances tend to (but need not) have (Rosch and Mervis 1975). Prototype theories are epistemic accounts because, on these views, having a concept is a matter of knowing the features of its prototypical instances. Given this, Fodor argues that prototype theories are also in danger of violating compositionality. For example, knowing what prototypical pets (dogs) are like and what prototypical fish (trout) are like does not guarantee that you know what prototypical pet fish (goldfish) are like (Fodor 1998a, pp. 102-108, Fodor and Lepore 2002, ch. 2). Since compositionality is required in order to explain the productivity and systematicity of thought, and prototype structures do not compose, it follows that concepts don’t have prototype structure. Fodor (1998b, ch. 4) extends this kind of argument to epistemic accounts that posit so-called “recognitional concepts,” that is, concepts that are individuated by certain recognitional capacities. (For discussion and criticism, see, for example, Horgan 1998, Recanati 2002, and Prinz 2002.)

Fodor thus rejects all theories that individuate concepts in terms of their epistemic properties and their internal structure, and ultimately defends what he calls “informational atomism,” according to which lexical concepts are unstructured atoms whose content is determined by certain informational relations they bear to phenomena in the environment. In claiming that lexical concepts are internally unstructured, Fodor’s informational atomism is meant to respect the evidence and arguments against decomposition, definitions, prototypes, and the like. In claiming that none of the epistemic properties of concepts are constitutive, Fodor is endorsing what he sees as the only alternative to molecularist and holistic theories of content, neither of which, as we’ve seen, he takes to be viable. By separating epistemology from semantics in this way, Fodor’s theory places virtually no constraints on what a thinker must believe or infer in order to possess a particular concept. For instance, what determines whether a mind possesses DOG isn’t whether it has certain beliefs about dogs, but rather whether it possess an internal symbol that stands in the appropriate mind-world relation to the property of being a dog. Rather than talking about concepts as they figure in beliefs, inferences, or other mental states, Fodor instead talks of mere “tokenings” of concepts, where for him these are internal symbols that need not play any specific role in cognition. In his view, this is the only way for a theory of concepts to respect Quinean strictures on analyticity and constitutive conceptual connections. Indeed, Fodor claims that by denying that “the grasp of any interconceptual relations is constitutive of concept possession,” informational atomism allows us to “see why Quine was right about there not being an analytic/synthetic distinction” (Fodor 1998a, p. 71).

Fodor’s most explicit characterization of the mind-world relation that determines content is his “asymmetry dependency” theory (1987, 1990). According to this theory, the concept DOG means dog because dogs cause tokenings of DOG, and non-dogs causing tokenings of DOG is asymmetrically dependent upon dogs causing DOG. In other words, non-dogs wouldn’t cause tokenings of DOG unless dogs cause tokenings of DOG, but not vice versa. This is Fodor’s attempt to meet Brentano’s challenge of providing a naturalistic sufficient condition for a symbol to have a meaning. Not surprisingly, many objections have been raised to Fodor’s asymmetric dependency theory; for an overview see Loewer and Rey 1991.

It’s important to see that in rejecting epistemic accounts of concepts Fodor is not claiming that epistemic properties are irrelevant from the perspective of a theory of concepts. For such properties are what sustain the laws that “lock” concepts onto phenomena in the environment. For instance, it is only because thinkers know a range of facts about dogs—what they look like, that they bark, and so forth—that the concept DOG is lawfully connected to dogs. Knowledge of such facts thus plays a causal role in fixing the content of DOG. But on Fodor’s view, this knowledge doesn’t play a constitutive role. While such epistemic properties mediate the connection between tokens of DOG and dogs, this a mere “engineering” fact about us, which has no implications for the metaphysics of concepts or concept possession (1998a, p. 78). As Fodor puts it, “it’s that your mental structures contrive to resonate to doghood, not how your mental structures contrive to resonate to doghood, that is constitutive of concept possession” (1998a, p. 76). Although the internal relations that DOG bears to other concepts and to percepts are what mediate the connection between DOG and dogs, on Fodor’s view such relations do not determine the content of DOG.

Fodor’s theory is a version of semantic externalism, according to which the meaning of a concept is exhausted by its reference. There are two well-known problems with any such referentialist theory: Frege cases, which putatively show that concepts that have different meanings can nevertheless be referentially identical; and Twin cases, which putatively show that concepts that are referentially distinct can nevertheless have the same meaning. Together, Frege cases and Twin cases suggest that meaning and reference are independent in both directions. Fodor has had much to say about each kind of case, and his views on both have changed over the years.

If conceptual content is exhausted by reference, then two concepts with the same referent ought to be identical in content. As Fodor says, “if meaning is information, then coreferential representations must be synonyms” (1998a, p. 12). But, prima facie, this is false. For as Frege pointed out, it’s easy to generate substitution failures involving coreferential concepts: “John believes that Hesperus is beautiful” may be true while “John believes that Phosphorus is beautiful” is false; “Thales believes that there’s water in the cup” may be true while “Thales believes that there’s H2O in the cup” is false; and so on. Since it’s widely believed that substitution tests are tests for synonymy, such cases suggest that coreferential concepts aren’t synonyms. In light of this, Fregeans introduce a layer of meaning in addition to reference that allows for a semantic distinction between coreferential but distinct concepts. On their view, coreferential concepts are distinct because they have different senses, or “modes of presentation” of a referent, which Fregeans typically individuate in terms of conceptual role (Peacocke 1992).

In one of Fodor’s important early articles on the topic, “Methodological Solipsism Considered as a Research Strategy in Cognitive Psychology” (1980), he argued that psychological explanations depend upon opaque taxonomies of mental states, and that we must distinguish the content of coreferential terms for the purposes of psychological explanation. At that time Fodor thus allowed for a kind of content that’s determined by the internal roles of symbols, which he speculated might be “reconstructed as aspects of form, at least insofar as appeals to content figure in accounts of the mental causation of behavior” (1980, p. 240). However, once he adopted a purely externalist semantics (Fodor 1994), Fodor could no longer allow for a notion of content determined by such internal relations. If conceptual content is exhausted by reference, as informational semantics has it, then there cannot be a semantic distinction between distinct but coreferential concepts.

In later work Fodor thus proposes to distinguish coreferential concepts purely syntactically, and defends the view that modes of presentation (MOPs) are the representational vehicles of thoughts (Fodor 1994, 1998a, 2008, Fodor and Pylyshyn 2014). Taking MOPs to be the syntactically-individuated vehicles of thought serves to connect the theory of concepts to RTM. As Fodor and Pylyshyn put it:

Frege just took for granted that, since coextensive thoughts (concepts) can be distinct, it must be difference in their intensions that distinguish them. But RTM, in whatever form, suggests another possibility: Thoughts and concepts are individuated by their extensions together with their vehicles. The concepts THE MORNING STAR and THE EVENING STAR are distinct because the corresponding mental representations are distinct. That must be so because the mental representation that expresses the concept THE MORNING STAR has a constituent that expresses the concept MORNING, but the mental representation that expresses the concept THE EVENING STAR does not. That’s why nobody can have the concept THE MORNING STAR who doesn’t have the concept MORNING and nobody can have the concept THE EVENING STAR who doesn’t have the concept EVENING. … The result of Frege’s missing this was a century during which philosophers, psychologists, and cognitive scientists in general spent wringing their hands about what meanings could possibly be. (2014, pp. 74-75)

An interesting consequence of this syntactic treatment is that people’s behavior in Frege cases can no longer be given an intentional explanation. Instead, such behavior is explained at the level of syntactically-individuated representations. If, as Fodor suggested in his earlier work (1981), psychological explanations standardly depend upon opaque taxonomies of mental states, then this treatment of Frege cases would threaten the need for intentional explanations in psychology. In an attempt to block this threat, Fodor (1994) argues that Frege cases are in fact quite rare, and can be understood as exceptions rather than counterexamples to psychological laws couched in terms of broad content. The viability of a view that combines a syntactic treatment of Frege cases with RTM has been the focus of a fair amount of literature; see Arjo 1997, Aydede 1998, Aydede and Robins 2001, Brook and Stainton 1997, Rives 2009, Segal 1997, and Schneider 2005.

Let us now turn to Fodor’s treatment of Twin cases. Putnam (1975) asks us to imagine a place, Twin Earth, which is just like earth except the stuff Twin Earthians pick out with the concept WATER is not H2O but some other chemical compound XYZ. Consider Oscar and Twin Oscar, who are both entertaining the thought THERE’S WATER IN THE GLASS. Since they’re physical duplicates, they’re type-identical with respect to everything mental inside their heads. However, Oscar’s thought is true just in case there’s H2O in the glass, whereas Twin Oscar’s thought is true just in case there’s XYZ in the glass. A purely externalist semantics thus seems to imply that Oscar and Twin Oscar’s WATER concepts are of distinct types, despite the fact that Oscar and Twin Oscar are type-identical with respect to everything mental inside their heads. Supposing that intentional laws are couched in terms of broad content, it would follow that Oscar’s and Twin Oscar’s water-directed behavior don’t fall under the same intentional laws.

Such consequences have seemed unacceptable to many, including Fodor, who in his book Psychosemantics (1987) argues that we need a notion of “narrow” content that allows us to account for the fact that Oscar’s and Twin-Oscar’s mental states will have the same causal powers despite differences in their environments. Fodor there defends a “mapping” notion of narrow content, inspired by David Kaplan’s work on demonstratives, according to which the narrow content of a concept is a function from contexts to broad contents (1987, ch. 2). The narrow content of Oscar’s and Twin Oscar’s concept WATER is thus a function that maps Oscar’s context onto the broad content H2O and Twin Oscar’s context onto the broad content XYZ. Such narrow content is shared because Oscar and Twin Oscar are computing the same function. It was Fodor’s hope that this notion of narrow content would allow him to respect the standard Twin-Earth intuitions, while at the same time claim that the intentional properties relevant for psychological explanation supervene on facts internal to thinkers.

However, in The Elm and the Expert (1994) Fodor gives up on the notion of narrow content altogether, and argues that intentional psychology need not worry about Twin cases. Such cases, Fodor claims, only show that it’s conceptually (not nomologically) possible that broad content doesn’t supervene on facts internal to thinkers. One thus cannot appeal to such cases to “argue against the nomological supervenience of broad content on computation since, as far as anybody knows … chemistry allows nothing that is as much like water as XYZ is supposed to be except water” (1994, p. 28). So since Putnam’s Twin Earth is nomologically impossible, and “empirical theories are responsible only to generalizations that hold in nomologically possible worlds,” Twin cases pose no threat to a broad content psychology (1994, p. 29). If it turned out that such cases did occur, then, according to Fodor, the generalizations missed by a broad content psychology would be purely accidental (1994, pp. 30-33). Fodor’s view is thus that Twin cases, like Frege cases, are fully compatible with an intentional psychology that posits only two dimensions to concepts: syntactically-individuated representations and broad contents. Much of Fodor’s work on concepts and content after The Elm and the Expert consisted of further articulation and defense of this view (Fodor 1998a, 2008, Fodor and Pylyshyn 2014).

6. Nativism

In The Language of Thought (1975), Fodor argued not only in favor of RTM but also in favor of the much more controversial view that all lexical concepts are innate. Fodor’s argument starts with the noncontroversial claim that in order to learn a concept one must learn its meaning, or content. But Fodor argues that any such account requires that learnable concepts have meanings that are semantically complex. For instance, if the meaning of BACHELOR is unmarried adult male, then a thinker can learn BACHELOR by confirming the hypothesis that it applies to things that are unmarried adult males. Of course, in order to formulate this hypothesis one must already possess the concepts UNMARRIED, ADULT, and MALE. Standard models of concept learning thus do not apply to primitive concepts that lack internal structure. For instance, one cannot formulate the hypothesis that red things fall under RED unless one already has RED, for the concept RED is a constituent of that very hypothesis. Therefore, primitive concepts like RED cannot be learned, that is, they must be innate. If, as Fodor argues, all lexical concepts are primitive, then it follows that all lexical concepts are innate (1975, ch. 2).

It bears emphasis that Fodor’s claim is not that experience plays no role in the acquisition of lexical concepts. Experience must play a role on any account of concept acquisition, just as it does on any account of language acquisition. Rather, Fodor’s claim is that lexical concepts are not learned on the basis of experience but triggered by it. As Fodor puts it in his most well-known article on the topic, “The Present Status of the Innateness Controversy,” his nativist claim is that the relation between experience and concept acquisition is brute-causal, not rational or evidential:

Nativists and Empiricists disagree on the extent to which the acquisition of lexical concepts is a rational process. In respect of this disagreement, the traditional nomenclature of “Rationalism vs. Empiricism” could hardly be more misleading. It is the Empiricist view that the relation between a lexical concept and the experiences which occasion its acquisition is normally rational—in particular, that the normal relation is that such experiences bestow inductive warrant upon hypotheses which articulate the internal structure of the concepts. Whereas, it’s the Rationalist view that the normal relation between lexical concepts and their occasioning experiences is brute-causal, i.e. “merely” empirical: such experiences function as the innately specified triggers of the concepts which they—to borrow the ethological jargon—“release”.  (1981b, pp. 279-280)

Most theories of concepts—such as conceptual role and prototype theories, discussed above—assume that many lexical concepts have some kind of internal structure. In fact, theorists are sometimes explicit that their motivation for positing complex lexical structure is to reduce the number of primitives in the lexicon. As Ray Jackendoff puts it:

Nearly everyone thinks that learning anything consists of constructing it from previously known parts, using previously known means of combination. If we trace the learning process back and ask where the previously known parts came from, and their previously know parts came from, eventually we have to arrive at a point where the most basic parts are not learned: they are given to the learner genetically, by virtue of the character of brain development. … Applying this view to lexical learning, we conclude that lexical concepts must have a compositional structure, and that the word learner’s [mind] is putting meanings together from smaller parts (2002, 334). (See also Levin and Pinker 1991, p. 4.)

It’s worth stressing that while those in the empiricist tradition typically assume that the primitives are sensory concepts, those who posit complex lexical structure need not commit themselves to any such empiricist claim. Rather, they may simply assume that very few lexical items not decomposable, and deal with the issue of primitives on a case by case basis, as Jackendoff (2002) does. In fact, many of the (apparent) primitives appealed to in the literature—for example, EVENT, THING, STATE, CAUSE, and so forth—are quite abstract and thus not ripe for an empiricist treatment. In any case, as we noted above, Fodor is led to adopt informational atomism, in part, because he is persuaded by the evidence that lexical concepts do not have any structure, decompositional or otherwise. He thus denies that appealing to lexical structure provides an adequate reply to his argument for concept nativism (Fodor 1981b, 1998a, 2008, Fodor and Lepore 2002).

In Concepts: Where Cognitive Science Went Wrong (1998a), Fodor worries about whether his earlier view is adequate. In particular, he’s concerned about whether it has the resources to explain questions such as why it is experiences with doorknobs that trigger the concept DOORKNOB:

[T]here’s a further constraint that whatever theory of concepts we settle on should satisfy: it must explain why there is so generally a content relation between the experience that eventuates in concept attainment and the concept that the experience eventuates in attaining. … [A]ssuming that primitive concepts are triggered, or that they’re ‘caught’, won’t account for their content relation to their causes; apparently only induction will. But primitive concepts can’t be induced; to suppose that they are is circular. (1998a, p. 132)

Fodor’s answer to this worry involves a metaphysical claim about the nature of the properties picked out by most of our lexical concepts. In particular, he claims that it’s constitutive of these properties that our minds “lock” to them as a result of experience with their prototypical (stereotypical) instances. As Fodor puts it, being a doorknob is just “being the kind of thing that our kinds of minds (do or would) lock to from experience with instances of the doorknob stereotype” (1998a, p. 137; see also 2008). By construing such properties as mind-dependent in this way, Fodor thus provides a metaphysical reply to his worry above: there need not be a cognitive or evidential relation between our experiences with doorknobs and our acquisition of DOORKNOB, for being a doorknob just is the property that our minds lock to as a result of experiencing stereotypical instances of doorknobs. Fodor sums up his view as follows:

[I]f the locking story about concept possession and the mind-dependence story about the metaphysics of doorknobhood are both true, then the kind of nativism about DOORKNOB that an informational atomist has to put up with is perhaps not one of concepts but of mechanisms. That consequence may be some consolation to otherwise disconsolate Empiricists. (1998a, p. 142)

In LOT 2: The Language of Thought Revisited (2008), Fodor extends his earlier discussions of concept nativism. Whereas his previous argument turned on the empirical claim that lexical concepts are internally unstructured, Fodor here says that this claim is “superfluous”: “What I should have said is that it’s true and a priori that the whole notion of concept learning is per se confused” (2008, p. 130). Consider a patently complex concept such as GREEN OR TRIANGULAR. Learning this concept would require confirming the hypothesis that the things that fall under it are either green or triangular. However, Fodor says:

[T]he inductive evaluation of that hypothesis itself requires (inter alia) bringing the property green or triangular before the mind as such. You can’t represent something as green or triangular unless you have the concepts GREEN, OR, and TRIANGULAR. Quite generally, you can’t represent anything as such and such unless you already have the concept such and such. … This conclusion is entirely general; it doesn’t matter whether the target concept is primitive (like GREEN) or complex (like GREEN OR TRIANGULAR). (2008, p. 139)

Fodor’s diagnosis of this problem is that standard learning models wrongly assume that acquiring a concept is a matter of acquiring beliefs. Instead, Fodor suggests that “beliefs are constructs out of concepts, not the other way around,” and that the failure to recognize this is what leads to the above circularity (2008, pp. 139-140; see also Fodor’s contribution to Piattelli-Palmarini, 1980).

Fodor’s story about concept nativism in LOT 2 runs as follows: although no concepts—not even complex ones—are learned, concept acquisition nevertheless involves inductive generalizations. We acquire concepts as a result of experiencing their prototypical instances, and learning a prototype is an inductive process. Of course, if concepts were prototypes then it would follow that concept acquisition would be an inductive process. But, as we saw above, Fodor claims that concepts can’t be prototypes since prototypes violate compositionality. Instead, Fodor suggests that learning a prototype is a stage in the acquisition of a concept. His picture thus looks like this (2008, p. 151):

Initial state → (P1) → stereotype/prototype formation → (P2) → locking (= concept attainment).

Why think that P1 is an inductive process? Fodor here appeals to “well-known empirical results suggesting that even very young infants are able to recognize and respond to statistical regularities in their environments,” and claims that “a genetically endowed capacity for statistical induction would make sense if stereotype formation is something that minds are frequently employed to do” (2008, p. 153). What renders this picture consistent with Fodor’s claim that “there can’t be any such thing as concept learning” (p. 139) is that he does not take P2 to be an inferential or intentional process (pp. 154-155). What kind of process is it? Here, Fodor doesn’t have much to say, other than it’s the “kind of thing that our sort of brain tissue just does”: “Psychology gets you from the initial state to P2; then neurology takes over and gets you the rest of the way to concept attainment” (p. 152). So, again, Fodor’s ultimate story about concept nativism is consistent with the view, as he puts it in Concepts, that “maybe there aren’t any innate ideas after all” (1998a, p. 143). Instead, there are innate mechanisms, which take us from the acquisition of prototypes to the acquisition of concepts.

7. Modularity

In his influential book, The Modularity of Mind (1983), Fodor argues that the mind contains a number of highly specialized, “modular” systems, whose operations are largely independent from each other and from the “central” system devoted to reasoning, belief fixation, decision making, and the like. In that book, Fodor was particularly interested in defending a modular view of perception against so-called “New Look” psychologists and philosophers (for example, Bruner, Kuhn, Goodman), who took cognition to be more or less continuous with perception. Whereas New Look theorists focused on evidence suggesting various top-down effects in perceptual processing (for example, ways in which what people believe and expect can affect what they see), Fodor was impressed by evidence from the other direction suggesting that perceptual processes lack access to such “background” information. Perceptual illusions provide a nice illustration. In the famous Müller-Lyer illusion (Figure 1), the top line looks longer than the bottom line even though they’re identical in length.

Muller Figure 1. The Müller-Lyer
Illusion

As Fodor points out, if knowing that the two lines are identical in length does not change the fact that one looks longer than the other, then clearly perceptual processes don’t have access to all of the information available to the perceiver. Thus, there must be limits on how much information is available to the visual system for use in perceptual inferences. In other words, vision must be in some interesting sense modular. The same goes for other sensory/input systems, and, on Fodor’s view, certain aspects of language processing.

Fodor spells out a number of characteristic features of modules. That knowledge of an illusion doesn’t make the illusion go away illustrates one of their central features, namely, that they are informationally encapsulated. Fodor says:

[T]he claim that input systems are informationally encapsulated is equivalent to the claim that the data that can bear on the confirmation of perceptual hypotheses includes, in the general case, considerably less that the organism may know. That is, the confirmation function for input systems does not have access to all the information that the organism internally represents. (1983, p. 69)

In addition, modules are supposed to be domain specific, in the sense that they’re restricted in the sorts of representations (such as visual, auditory, or linguistic) that can serve as their inputs (1983, pp. 47-52). They’re also mandatory. For instance, native English speakers cannot hear utterances of English as mere noise (“You all know what Swedish and Chinese sound like; what does English sound like?” 1983, p. 54), and people with normal vision and their eyes open cannot help but see the 3-D objects in front of them. In general, modules “approximate the condition so often ascribed to reflexes: they are automatically triggered by the stimuli that they apply to” (1983, pp. 54-55). Not only are modular processes domain-specific and out of our voluntary control, they’re also exceedingly fast. For instance, subjects can “shadow” speech (repeat what is heard when it’s heard) with a latency of about 250 milliseconds, and match a description to a picture with 96% accuracy when exposed for a mere 167 milliseconds (1983, pp. 61-64). In addition, modules have shallow outputs, in the sense that the information they carry is simple, or constrained in some way, which is required because otherwise the processing required to generate them couldn’t be encapsulated. As Fodor says, “if the visual system can deliver news about protons, then the likelihood that visual analysis is informationally encapsulated is negligible” (1983, p. 87). Fodor tentatively suggests that the visual system delivers as outputs “basic” perceptual categories (Rosch et al. 1976) such as dog or chair, although others take shallow outputs to be altogether non-conceptual (Carruthers 2006, p. 4). In addition to these features, Fodor also suggests that modules are associated with fixed neural architecture, exhibit characteristic and specific breakdown patterns, and have an ontogeny that exhibits a characteristic pace and sequencing (1983, pp. 98-101).

On Fodor’s view, although sensory systems are modular, the “central” systems underlying belief fixation, planning, decision-making, and the like, are not. The latter exhibit none of the characteristic features associated with modules since they are domain-general, unencapsulated, under our voluntary control, slow, and not associated with fixed neural structures. Fodor draws attention, in particular, to two distinguishing features of central systems: they’re isotropic, in the sense that “in principle, any of one’s cognitive commitments (including, of course, the available experiential data) is relevant to the (dis)confirmation of any new belief” (2008, p. 115); and they’re Quinean, in the sense that they compute over the entirety of one’s belief system, as when one settles on the simplest, most conservative overall belief—as Fodor puts it, “the degree of confirmation assigned to any given hypothesis is sensitive to properties of the entire belief system” (1983, p. 107). Fodor’s picture of mental architecture is one in which there are a number of informationally encapsulated modules that process the outputs of transducer systems, and then generate representations that are integrated in a non-modular central system. The Fodorean mind is thus essentially a big general-purpose computer, with a number of domain-specific computers out near the edges that feed into it.

Fodor’s work on modularity has been criticized on a number of fronts. Empiricist philosophers and psychologists are typically quite happy with the claim that the central system is domain-general, but have criticized Fodor’s claim that input systems are modular (see Prinz 2006 for an overview). Fodor’s work has also been attacked by those who share his rationalist and nativist sympathies. Most notably, evolutionary psychologists reject Fodor’s claim that there must be a non-modular system responsible for integrating modular outputs, and argue instead that the mind is nothing but a collection of modular systems (see Barkow, Cosmides, and Tooby 1992, Carruthers 2006, Pinker 1997, and Sperber 2002). According to such “massive modularity” theorists, what Fodor calls the “central” system is in fact built up out of a number of domain-specific modules, for example, modules devoted to common-sense reasoning about physics, biology, psychology, and the detection of cheaters, to name a few prominent examples from the literature. (The notion of “module” used by such theorists is different in various ways from the notion as introduced by Fodor; see Carruthers 2006 and Barrett 2015.) In addition, evolutionary psychologists claim that these central modules are adaptations, that is, products of selection pressures that faced our hominid ancestors.

That Fodor is a staunch nativist might lead one to believe that he is sympathetic to applying adaptationist reasoning to the human mind. This would be a mistake. Fodor has long been skeptical of the idea that the mind is a product of natural selection, and in his book The Mind Doesn’t Work That Way (2001) he replies to a number of arguments purporting to show that it must be. For instance, evolutionary psychologists claim that the mind must be “reverse engineered”: in order to figure out how it works, we must know what its function is; and in order to know what its function is we must know what it was selected for. Fodor rejects this latter inference, and claims that natural selection is not required in order to underwrite claims about the teleology of the mind. For the notion of function relevant for psychology might be synchronic, not diachronic: “You might think, after all, that what matters in understanding the mind is what ours do now, not what our ancestors’ did some millions of years ago” (1998b, p. 209). Indeed, in general, one does not need to know about the evolutionary history of a system in order to make inferences about its function:

[O]ne can often make a pretty shrewd guess what an organ is for on the basis of entirely synchronic considerations. One might thus guess that hands are for grasping, eyes for seeing, or even that minds are for thinking, without knowing or caring much about their history of selection. Compare Pinker (1997, p. 38): “psychologists have to look outside psychology if they want to explain what the parts of the mind are for.” Is this true? Harvey didn’t have to look outside physiology to explain what the heart is for. It is, in particular, morally certain that Harvey never read Darwin. Likewise, the phylogeny of bird flight is still a live issue in evolutionary theory. But, I suppose, the first guy to figure out what birds use their wings for lived in a cave. (2000, p. 86)

Fodor’s point is that even if one grants that natural selection underwrites teleological claims about the mind, it doesn’t follow that in order to understand a psychological mechanism one must understand the selection pressures that led to it.

Evolutionary psychologists also argue that the adaptive complexity of the mind is best explained by the hypothesis that it is a collection of adaptations. For natural selection is the only known explanation for adaptive complexity in the living world. In response, Fodor claims that the complexity of our minds is irrelevant to the question of whether they’re the products of natural selection:

[W]hat matters to the plausibility that the architecture of our minds is an adaptation is how much genotypic alternation would have been required for it to evolve from the mind of the nearest ancestral ape whose cognitive architecture was different from ours. About that, however, nothing is known. … [I]t’s entirely possible that quite small neurological reorganizations could have effected wild psychological discontinuities between our minds and the ancestral ape’s. … If that’s right, then there is no reason at all to believe that our cognition was shaped by the gradual action of Darwinian selection on prehuman behavioral phenotypes. (2000, pp. 87-88)

Fodor thus argues that adaptive complexity does not warrant the claim that our minds are products of natural selection. In a co-authored book with Massimo Piattelli-Palmarini, What Darwin Got Wrong (2010), Fodor goes much further, arguing that adaptationist explanations in general are both decreasingly of interest in biology and, on further reflection, actually incoherent. Perhaps needless to say, the book has occasioned considerable controversy (see Sober 2010, Pigliucci 2010, Block and Kitcher 2010, and Godfrey-Smith 2010; Fodor and Piattelli-Palmarini reply to their critics in an afterword in the paperback edition of the book).

In The Mind Doesn’t Work That Way (2000), and also in LOT 2 (2008), Fodor reiterates and defends his claim that the central systems are non-modular, and connects this view to more general doubts about the adequacy of RTM as a comprehensive theory of the human mind, doubts that he first voiced in his classic The Modularity of Mind (1983). One of the main jobs of the central system is the fixation of belief via abductive inferences, and Fodor argues that the fact that such inferences are holistic, global, and context-dependent implies that they cannot be realized in a modular system. Given RTM’s commitment to the claim that computational processes are sensitive only to local properties of mental representations, these features of central cognition thus appear to fall outside of RTM’s scope (2000, chs. 2-3; 2008, ch. 4).

Consider, for instance, the simplicity of a belief. As Fodor says: “The thought that there will be no wind tomorrow significantly complicates your arrangements if you had intended to sail to Chicago, but not if your plan was to fly, drive, or walk there” (2000, p. 26). Whether or not a belief complicates a plan thus depends upon the beliefs involved in the plan—that is, the simplicity of a belief is one of its global, context-dependent properties. However, the syntactic properties of representations are local, in the sense that they depend on their intrinsic, context-independent properties. Fodor concludes that to the extent that cognition involves global properties of representations, RTM cannot provide a model of how cognition works:

[A] cognitive science that provides some insight into the part of the mind that isn’t modular may well have to be different, root and branch, from the kind of syntactical account that Turing’s insights inspired. It is, to return to Chomsky’s way of talking, a mystery, not just a problem, how mental processes could be simultaneously feasible and abductive and mechanical. Indeed, I think that, as things now stand, this and consciousness look to be the ultimate mysteries about the mind. (2000, p. 99).

Thus, although Fodor has long championed RTM as the best theory of cognition available, he claims that its application is limited to those portions of the mind that are modular. Needless to say, some disagree with Fodor’s assessment of the limits of RTM (see Carruthers 2006, Ludwig and Schneider 2008, Pinker 2005, and Barrett 2015).

8. References and Further Reading

  • Arjo, Dennis (1996) “Sticking Up for Oedipus: Fodor on Intentional Generalizations and Broad Content,” Mind & Language 11: 231-235.
  • Aydede, Murat (1998) “Fodor on Concepts and Frege Puzzles,” Pacific Philosophical Quarterly 79: 289-294.
  • Aydede, Murat & Philip Robbins (2001) “Are Frege Cases Exceptions to Intentional Generalizations?” Canadian Journal of Philosophy 31: 1-22.
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Author Information

Bradley Rives
Email: rives@iup.edu
Indiana University of Pennsylvania
U. S. A.

The Trinity

Christians believe that God is a Trinity of Persons, each omnipotent, omniscient and wholly benevolent, co-equal and fully divine. There are not three gods, however, but one God in three Persons: Father, Son and Holy Spirit. Prima facie, the doctrine more commonly known as the Trinity seems gratuitous: why multiply divine beings beyond necessity—especially since one God is hard enough to believe in? For Christians, however, the Trinity doctrine is neither gratuitous nor unmotivated. Claims about Christ’s divinity are difficult to reconcile with the Christian doctrine that there is just one God: Trinitarian theology is an attempt to square the Christian conviction that Jesus is the Son of God, fully divine yet distinct from his Father, with the Christian commitment to monotheism. Nevertheless, while the Trinity doctrine purports to solve a range of theological puzzles it poses a number of intriguing logical difficulties akin to those suggested by the identity of spatio-temporal objects through time and across worlds, puzzle cases of personal identity, and problems of identity and constitution. Philosophical discussions of the Trinity have suggested solutions to the Trinity puzzle comparable to solutions proposed to these classic identity puzzles. When it comes to the Trinity puzzle, however, one must determine whether such solutions accord with theological constraints.

Table of Contents

  1. History and Motivation
    1. Why Should One Believe It?
    2. God and World: The Great Chain of Being and the Bright Line
    3. Trinity East and West: Loose and Descending or Tight and Flat?
    4. The Industry Standard: Nicea and Beyond
  2. Theological Constraints
    1. Monotheism
    2. The Distinctness of Persons
    3. The Equality of Persons, the Descending Trinity and the Filioque Clause
    4. Personality
    5. Christology and the Jesus Predicate Problem
  3. Philosophical Puzzles and Solutions
    1. Trinity and Identity
    2. The “Is” of Predication
    3. Divine Stuff: ‘God’ as a Mass Term
    4. Relative Identity
    5. The Trinity and Other Identity Puzzles
  4. References and Further Reading

1. History and Motivation

a. Why Should One Believe It?

Why should one believe that God is a Trinity of Persons? Historically, most writers have held that even if the existence of God could be known by natural reason, his Trinitarian character could only be discovered through revelation.  Such revelations in the tradition of the Church can only be indirectly encountered through the explication and interpretation of Scripture. This was, for example, Aquinas’ view. However, other writers have suggested that even discounting revelation, reflection on the nature of God should lead us to recognize his Trinitarian character. For instance, Richard Swinburne argues that there is at least a plausibility argument for a Trinity of divine persons insofar as God’s perfectly loving nature drives the production of the Trinitarian Persons:

I believe that there is overriding reason for a first divine individual to bring about a second divine individual and with him to bring about a third divine individual…[L]ove is a supreme good. Love involves sharing, giving to the other what of one’s own is good for him and receiving from the other what of his is good for one; and love involves co-operating with another to benefit third parties. [Richard Swinburne, The Christian God, p. 177-178]

However, this is a minority view, as other contemporary writers reject a prioriarguments for the doctrine of the Trinity.  For example, Brian Leftow challenges it by asking why perfect love should stop at three rather than four or more.

If natural reason fails to provide a compelling reason to regard God as Trinitarian, an appeal to Scripture does not fare much better. There are few hints in the Bible of the Trinity doctrine, which developed later during the Patristic period. The Trinitarian formula figures in injunctions to baptize “in the name of the Father, Son and Holy Spirit” in Matthew 28:19, but both twofold and threefold patterns occur in the New Testament, and there is no mention of the Trinity as such. Rausch in The Trinitarian Controversy notes:

The binatarian formulas are found in Rom 8:11, 2 Cor. 4:14, Gal. 1:1, Eph. 1:20, 1 Tim. 1:2, 1 Pet. 1:21 and 2 John 1:13. The triadic schema is discovered in Matt. 28:19, 1 Cor. 6:11 and 12:4, Gal. 3:11-14, Heb. 10:29, and 1 Pet. 1:2. All these passages indicate that there is no fixity of wording. No doctrine of the Trinity in the Nicene sense is present in the New Testament. (William G. Rusch. The Trinitarian Controversy. Philadelphia: Fortress Press, 1980. P. 2)

Despite this ambiguity, the Gospels do pose puzzles that motivate the development of Trinitarian doctrine. First, they represent Jesus as both the Son of Man, who prays to the Father, and as a divine being, identified in the Fourth Gospel with the Logos, who is “with God and is God,” [John 1:1] and who also announces that he and the Father are “one” [John 10:30]. Second, Scripture speaks of the Spirit who descended on Jesus’ disciples at Pentecost, and who also is conventionally identified with the Spirit that moved over the waters at Creation in Genesis. Arguably, we may regard the Trinity doctrine as an explanatory hypothesis, which purports to make sense of divinity claims concerning the Son and Holy Spirit without undermining the Judeo-Christian commitment to monotheism.

b. God and World: The Great Chain of Being and the Bright Line

The Trinity doctrine is also part of a larger theological project. In the early Christian Era of the Hebrew tradition, there was a plurality of divine, semi-divine and otherwise supernatural beings, which has to be reconciled with Hebraic monotheism. Some of these beings, such as Yahweh’s suite of Seraphim and Cherubim, are indigenous; others were absorbed from Hellenistic religious culture. In the interests of an orderly theological monotheism, these beings have to be defined in relation to God. Some were absorbed into the Godhead as aspects, powers or components of the one God, others were demoted to angelic or demonic status, and yet others were dismissed as the mere hypostatizations of theological façons de parler. The doctrine of the Trinity emerged as part of that theological tidying up process, which, from the Judeo-Christian side, was aimed at drawing a bright line between the one God and everything else.

If Jews and Christians (insofar as they were faithful to their Hebraic roots), were intent on separating out the one God from all other things visible and invisible, Greeks had no compunction about multiplying supernatural beings. Indeed, the Greek problem of “the one and the many” was one of filling the gap between a simple, impassible, atemporal, incorporeal, incorruptible deity and a world of matter, the passive recipient of form, which was temporal, corporeal, and corruptible.

The traditional response was to introduce one or more divine, semi-divine or otherwise supernatural beings to mediate between the One and the many. So Plato, in the Timaeus, speculated that the material world had been created by the Demiurge, a Second God. This strategy was elaborated upon during the late Hellenistic period in Gnostic systems, which introduced elaborate systems of “emanations” from the divine in a continuum, a Great Chain of Being that stretched from the most elevated of beings, through intermediaries, and to those who were sufficiently remote from full divinity to be involved with the world of matter. During the Hellenistic period, Christians and Jews engaged in philosophical theology, like Origen and Philo, adopted similar views since Philosophy was of the Greeks, and the philosophical lingua franca was Platonism.

In contrast, there was no reason to construct a Great Chain of Being within the Hebrew tradition. The writers of Hebrew Scripture did not have any compelling philosophical interests and did not look for mechanisms to explain how things came into being or operated: fiat was good enough. Perhaps more importantly, they did not view materiality as inherently imperfect or defective and so did not need to posit mediating beings to bridge an ontological gap between the divine and base matter, a feature of the Greek tradition. This tradition, though it continued to figure in popular piety, was officially repudiated by orthodox Christians. Yahweh, according to the Genesis accounts, created the world by fiat—no mechanism required—and saw that it was good.

For philosophical theologians in the grip of the problem of the One and the many, fiat would not do—and for Christian theologians, committed to monotheism, the doctrine of mediating divine or semi-divine beings posed special difficulties. As heirs to the Hebrew tradition, they recognized a fundamental ontological dividing line between a divine Creator and his creation and faced the problem of which side of the line the mediating being or beings occupied—exacerbated by the monotheistic assumption that there was only room for one Being on the side of the Creator.

c. Trinity East and West: Loose and Descending or Tight and Flat?

The Trinity Doctrine was an attempt to accommodate both partisans of the Bright Line and also partisans of the Great Chain of Being including Christians who identified Jesus with the Logos, a mediating divine being through which the material world was created. Jews wanted to absorb all divine beings into the one God in the interests of promoting monotheism; Greeks wanted mediating beings to bridge the ontological gap between the world of time and change, and the transcendent reality beyond. In identifying the Logos, incarnate in Christ, as the Second Person of the Trinity, Christians aimed to bridge the ontological gap with a mediating being who was himself incorporated into the Godhead, satisfying the metaphysical interests of both Greeks and Jews.

Elaborated over three centuries before reaching its mature form in the ecumenical councils of Nicea (325 AD) and Constantinople (381 AD), the doctrine of the Trinity represents an attempt to organize and make sense of the Christian conviction that God created the material world, sustained it and acted within history, most particularly through Christ and in his Church. On this account, God creates all things through the Logos and enters into the world in Christ. Jesus promises that he will not abandon his people but that after ascending to his Father will send the Holy Spirit to guide his Church. The Logos and Holy Spirit are not merely supernatural beings of an inferior order who do God’s business in the world: according to the Biblical tradition the material world is not an inferior realm to be handled by inferior mediating beings. Accordingly, Christians needed to hold that the Logos and Holy Spirit were fully divine. To preserve monotheism, however, there could not be divine beings other than God, so Christians were pressed to incorporate the Logos and Holy Spirit into the divine nature.

The tension between those two theological interests shaped the ongoing development of Trinitarian doctrine insofar as the goal of Christian orthodoxy was to make sense of the role of Christ as a mediating divine being—God with us, the Word made flesh through which all things were made—while maintaining the bright line between a transcendent, divine being and everything else in the interests of supporting monotheism. Painting with a broad brush, the former concern drove the development of Trinitarian doctrine that evolved into the Eastern tradition of Social Trinitarianism; the latter shaped the theology of Latin Trinitarianism that came to dominate the West.

Social Trinitarians, in the interests of explaining Christ’s mediating role, conceive of the Trinity as a divine society, each member of which is fully personal, each a center of consciousness, each involved in a loving relationship with the others. This view puts pressure on monotheism; however, advocates suggest that the cost is worth it in order to accommodate what they regard as compelling religious interests. Scripture represents Christ as communicating interpersonally with his Father, praying and being commended as the Son with whom his Father is well pleased. Social Trinitarians regard this sort of relationship as religiously important insofar as it models, in an ideal form, the relationship between God and us, and also between us and our fellows. In addition, the picture of the Trinity as a loving divine society makes sense of the notion of God as Love. For Social Trinitarians, in any case, the fundamental problem is one of making sense of the unity of Persons in one divine Being and this is, indeed, the project of the theologians credited with being the progenitors of Social Trinitarianism: the Cappadocian Fathers, Basil, Gregory of Nazianzus and Gregory of Nyssa.

Latin Trinitarians, by contrast, begin with the God’s unity as given and seek to explain how the Persons may be distinguished one from another. If Social Trinitarians understand the Trinity as a society of Persons, Latin Trinitarians represent the Trinity in toto as an individual and imagine the Persons generated in some manner by the relations among them. In this vein, St. Augustine suggests that the Trinity is analogous to the mind, its knowledge of itself and love of itself, which are distinct but inseparable (Augustine, On the Trinity). Nevertheless, while Latin Trinitarianism makes monotheism unproblematic, it poses difficulties concerning the apparently interpersonal communication between Jesus and his Father, and in addition raises questions about how the Persons, in particular the Holy Spirit, can be understood as personal.

Although Social Trinitarianism and Latin Trinitarianism fall within the scope of Nicene orthodoxy, it may be instructive to consider the difference in heterodox views that emerge in the East and West. When Social Trinitarianism goes bad it degrades into Subordinationism, a family of doctrines that assign an inferiority of being, status or role to the Son and Holy Spirit within the Trinity, which has its roots in the emanationist theologies that proliferated in the Hellenistic world. This view is classically represented in the theology of the heresiarch Arius, who held that the Son was a mere creature, albeit “the first-born of all creation.” Eastern theology tends towards a “loose,” descending Trinity, to tri-theism and subordinationism and so Arianism is the characteristic Eastern heresy.

Western theology, by contrast favors a “tight,” flat Trinity and in the first centuries of the Christian era tended toward ultra-high Christologies like Apollinarianism, the doctrine that, crudely, Jesus was a man in whom the Logos took the place normally occupied by a human rational soul, and Monophytism, according to which Christ had only one nature, and that divine. If the characteristic Trinitarian heresy in the East was Arianism, the characteristic Western heresies belong to a family of heterodox views generically known as Monarchianism, a term coined by Tertullian to designate tight-Trinity doctrines in virtue of their emphasis on the unity of God as the single and only ruler or source of Being, including most notably Modalism (a.k.a. Sabellianism), the doctrine that the Persons of the Trinity are merely “modes,” aspects or offices of the one God.

d. The Industry Standard: Nicea and Beyond

There is enough doctrinal space between Arianianism and Sabellianism to accommodate a range of theological accounts of the Trinity within the scope of Nicene orthodoxy. The Nicene formula declared that the Son was homoousios, “of the same substance” as the Father, which was elaborated by the Cappadocian Fathers in the dictum that the Persons of the Trinity were one ousia but three hypostases. This knocked out Arians on the one side and Sabellians on the other, but left room for a range of interpretations in between since “ousia” was, notoriously, ambiguous. Aristotle had used the term to designate both individuals, substances that are bearers of essences and properties, and the essential natures of individuals, the natural kinds in virtue of which they are substances in the first sense. So, individual human beings are substances in the first sense, and the human nature they share, the natural kind to which they belong, is a substance in the second sense.

The Nicene homoousios formula inherited the ambiguity. Understood in one way, the claim that the Persons of the Trinity were “homoousios” said that the Persons were the same individual, skating dangerously close to the Sabellian claim that they were “monoousios”—of one substance. Understood in the other way, it said merely that they were of the same kind, an interpretation compatible with tri-theism. The Cappadocians attempted to clarify and disambiguate the Nicene formula by employing the term “hypostasis,” used earlier by Origen, to capture the notion of individual identity rather than identity of kind. By itself, this did not solve the problem. First, apart from their revisionary theological usage, ousia and hypostasis were virtual synonyms: as a solution to the Trinity puzzle this formula was rather like saying that the Persons were one thing but different objects. Secondly, “one ousia” still failed to rule out tri-theism—indeed, in non-theological cases, one ousia, many hypostases is precisely what different individuals of the same species are. Homoousios, as intended, ruled out the doctrine that Father and Son were merely similar kinds of beings—homoiousios—but it did not rule out their being distinct individuals of the same kind.

The Cappadocian dictum, however, provided a framework for further discussion of the Trinity puzzle: the Trinitarian Persons were to be understood as being the same something but different something-elses and the substantive theological question was that of characterizing the ways in which they were bound together and individuated.

As to the latter question, Nicea opened the discussion of the “theology” of the Trinity, understood as the exploration of the relations amongst Persons—the “immanent Trinity” as distinct from the “economic Trinity,” that is the Trinity understood in terms of the distinct roles of the Persons in their worldly activities, in creation, redemption and sanctification. Nicea cashed out the homoousios claim by noting that the Son was “begotten, not made” indicating that he was, as noted in a parallel formula then current, “out of the Father’s ousia.” Furthermore, the Holy Spirit was declared at Constantinople to have the same sort of ontological status as the Son. So in the Fourth Century, at the Councils of Nicea and Constantinople, and through the work of the Cappadocians, the agenda for Trinitarian theology was set and the boundaries of orthodoxy were marked.

Within these parameters, the Trinity doctrine poses problems of three sorts: first, theological problems in reconciling theological doctrines concerning the character and properties of God with Trinitarian claims; secondly, theological puzzles that arise from Christological claims in particular; and finally logical puzzles posed by the Trinity doctrine itself. It remains to be seen whether it is possible to formulate a coherent doctrine of the Trinity within the constraints of Christian orthodoxy.

2. Theological Constraints

a. Monotheism

Christians claim to be monotheists and yet, given the doctrine of the Trinity, hold that there are three beings who are fully divine, viz. God the Father, Son and Holy Spirit. The first Trinity puzzle is that of explaining how we can attribute full divinity to the Persons of the Trinity without either compromising monotheism or undermining claims about the distinctness of Trinitarian persons.

Orthodox accounts of the Trinity hover uneasily between Sabellianism—which construes Trinitarian Persons as mere phases, aspects or offices of one God—and tri-theism, according to which the Persons are three Gods. Tri-theism is unacceptable since it is incompatible with the historical Christian commitment to monotheism inherited from the Hebrew tradition.

The fundamental problem for Trinitarian orthodoxy is to develop a doctrine of the Trinity that fits in the space between Sabellianism (or other versions of Monarchianism) and tri-theism. For Social Trinitarians in particular the problem has been one of articulating an account of the Trinity that affirms the individuality of the Persons and their relationships with one another without lapsing into tri-theism.

b. The Distinctness of Persons

Historically, Monarchianism—in particular Modalism (or Sabellianism), the doctrine that the Persons are “modes,” aspects, or roles of God—has been more tempting to Christians than tri-theism. The fundamental problem orthodox Latin Trinitarians face is that of maintaining a distinction between Trinitarian Persons sufficient to avoid Sabellianism, since orthodox Christians hold that the Persons of the Trinity are not merely aspects of God or God under different descriptions but in some sense distinct individuals such that Father ≠ Son ≠ Holy Spirit.

Christians hold that there are properties that distinguish the Persons. First, there are intra–Trinitarian relational properties the Persons have in virtue of their relations to other Trinitarian Persons: the Father begets the Son, but the Son does not beget the Son; the Spirit proceeds from the Father (and the Son) but neither the Father nor the Son proceeds from the Father (and the Son). Secondly, the Persons of the Trinity are distinguished in virtue of their distinctive “missions”—their activities in the world. The Second Person of the Trinity becomes incarnate, is born, suffers, dies, is buried, rises from the dead and ascends to the Father. According to orthodox doctrine, however, the same is not true of the Father (or Holy Spirit) and, indeed, the doctrine that the Father became incarnate, suffered and died is the heresy of patripassionism.

According to Latin Trinitarians, God, the Trinity, is an individual rather than a community of individuals sharing the same divine nature and each Person of the Trinity is that individual. Given this account however, the trick is to block inferences from the ascription of properties characteristic of one Trinitarian Person to the ascription of those properties to other Persons. Moreover, since it is held that the Persons cannot be individuated by their worldly activities, Latin Trinitarians, whose project is to explain the distinctions between Persons, must develop an account of the intra–Trinitarian relations that distinguish them—a project which is at best speculative.

c. The Equality of Persons, the Descending Trinity and the Filioque Clause

Supposing that we tread the fine line, and succeed in affirming both the participation of Trinitarian Persons in one God and their distinctness. Orthodoxy then requires, in addition, that we hold the Persons of the Trinity to be equal in power, knowledge, goodness and all properties pertaining to divinity other than those that are specific to the Persons individually. This poses problems when it comes to divine agency. Assuming that doing A and doing A* are equally good, it is logically possible that one Person may prefer A while another prefers A* (and that the third is, perhaps, indifferent). In the absence of a tie-breaker, it is hard to see how the Trinity can get anything done! If the Person who prefers A and the Person who prefers A* stick to their guns, neither can accomplish his end so it would seem, neither can count as omnipotent; if they defer to one another they also end up in a deadlock.

This is a difficulty for Social Trinitarians in particular insofar as they understand the Trinitarian Persons as distinct centers of consciousness and will whose projects might be incompatible. Swinburne, a Social Trinitarian, attempts to avoid this difficulty by suggesting that the Father, in virtue of his character as the Source of Trinitarian Persons, has the authority to “lay down the rules” so that irresolvable conflicts amongst Trinitarian Persons will be avoided (Swinburne, pp. 172-173). If however we assume that the preferences of one Trinitarian person take precedence so that the other Persons willingly defer to him as a matter of policy, then it is hard to avoid the suspicion that some Persons of the Trinity are “more equal than others”—the heresy of Subordinationism.

Even if Social Trinitarians avoid Subordinationism, the descending account of the Trinity according to which the defining characteristic of the Father is that of being the Source of Trinitarian Persons has theological ramifications which, in the end, resulted in the defining controversy between Eastern and Western churches concerning the Filioque clause. The original version of the Creed formulated by the councils of Nicea and Constantinople, declares that the Holy Spirit proceeds from the Father (ek tou Patros ek poreuomenon). The Filioque Clause, affirming that the Holy Spirit proceeds from the Father and the Son (ex Patri Filioque procedit), which first appeared in the profession of faith formulated at the Council of Toledo in 589, spread throughout Gaul and eventually become normative in the West, was firmly rejected by the Eastern churches on the grounds that it undermined the doctrine that the Father was the Source of Trinitarian Persons and the personality of the Holy Spirit.

Photios, the 9th Century Patriarch of Constantinople who initiated the Photian Schism between East and West, argues in The Mystogogy of the Holy Spirit that the procession of the Holy Spirit from the Son as well as the Father implies that the Father is not up to the task of generating Trinitarian Persons. Either the Father can do the job on his own or he can’t. If he can, then the participation of the Son in the generation of the Holy Spirit is superfluous and so there is no reason to accept the Filioque Clause. If he can’t, then he is a theological failure, which is absurd. Photios, representing the Eastern tradition, assumes a descending account of the Trinity according to which the characteristic hypostatic property of the Father is his role as the Source of the other Trinitarian Persons. He assumes in addition that all properties of Trinitarian Persons are such that they are either generic properties of divinity, and so are shared by all Persons, or hypostatic properties possessed uniquely by the Persons they characterize. It follows from these assumptions that the Filioque Clause should be rejected.

Photios and other Eastern theologians worried also that the Western account of the Trinity undermined the personal character of the Holy Spirit. According to one metaphor, widely employed in the West, the Father, Son and Holy Spirit are analogous to the Lover, the Beloved and the Love between them. Love is not the sort of thing that can have psychological properties or count as a person and so Eastern theologians charged that the “flat” Trinitarian picture that dominated Western Trinitarian theology, in which the Holy Spirit was understood as a relation or mediator between Father and Son undermined the personhood of the Holy Spirit.

Is the “descending” picture at the heart of Eastern Trinitarian theology, according to which the Father is characteristically the progenitor of Trinitarian Persons, inherently subordinationist? It does not seem to be so since there is no compelling reason why we should regard the property of being the Source of Trinitarian persons as one that confers superior status or authority on its possessor. Some parents are smarter, better looking, and richer than their children; others are dumber, uglier, and poorer. When children are young their parents legitimately exercise authority over them; when they are grown up they become their parents’ peers. To the extent that the role of the Father as the Source of Trinitarian Persons is analogous to human parenthood there is no reason to regard the Father as in any respect superior to the other Persons and it is hard to see what other reason could be given for this view.

Nevertheless, the descending Trinity picture lends itself to subordinatist interpretations in a way that the flat Trinity model does not. So when, for example, Swinburne suggests that the Father’s essential character as Source of Trinitarian Persons confers on him the authority to resolve intra–Trinitarian disputes or entitles him to the deference of other Trinitarian Persons he is, at the very least, skating close to the edge of Subordinationism.

d. Personality

Finally, Christians hold that God is personal—the subject of psychological states. But what is personal: the Trinity in toto or the Persons individually? The Litany, which addresses the Persons individually, and the Trinity in toto suggests all of the above:

O God the Father, Creator of heaven and earth; Have mercy upon us.
O God the Son, Redeemer of the world; Have mercy upon us.
O God the Holy Ghost, Sanctifier of the faithful; Have mercy upon us.
O holy, blessed, and glorious Trinity, one God: Have mercy upon us.

But this does not seem to be a coherent position. If the Father, Son and Holy Spirit are distinct centers of consciousness, the sorts of beings to whom one can reasonably appeal for mercy, and the Trinity is a divine society as Social Trinitarians suggest, it would seem that the Trinity could not itself be personal in any robust sense. After invoking the Father, Son and Holy Ghost, the invocation of the Trinity seems superfluous—as if I were to ask permission to build a fence on our adjoining property lines from each of my neighbors and then get them together to ask permission of them as a group.

On the face of it Latin Trinitarians have an easier time explaining what is personal: it is God, the Trinity and the Persons are individually personal to the extent that each is God. The Father is God so insofar as God, the Trinity, is personal, the Father is personal; the Son and Holy Spirit are God so they too are personal. The invocations in the Litany are indeed redundant because all four invoke no one other than God, but that is just a matter of poetic license. Nevertheless, some Christians, in particular Eastern Christians who are sympathetic to the Social Trinitarianism, worry that some metaphors Latin Trinitarians exploit undermine the personal character of the Holy Spirit. In addition, Latin Trinitarianism makes Gospel accounts of Jesus’ praying to the Father difficult to make out. Who was praying to whom? On the Latin Trinitarian account it seems that, insofar as we identify Jesus with the Second Person of the Trinity, God was simply talking to himself.

e. Christology and the Jesus Predicate Problem

The doctrine of the Trinity, as noted earlier, is motivated by the Christian conviction that Jesus was, in some sense, divine. Jesus however was born, suffered under Pontius Pilate, was crucified, died and was buried; he did not understand Chinese; he believed that David was the author of all the Psalms. These properties are, it would seem, incompatible with divinity and, indeed, there appear to be a great many predicates that are true of Jesus which, it would seem, could not be true of God and vice versa.

This is the Jesus Predicate Problem: we do not want to ascribe all the predicates that are true of Jesus to God simpliciter or, in particular, to God the Father. We do not, for example, want to hold that the Father suffered on the Cross—the heresy of Patripassionism. God, as traditionally understood is impassible—he cannot be subject to suffering, pain or harm. Moreover God has no beginning in time or end, and is, according to most orthodox accounts atemporal insofar as he is eternal rather than merely everlasting: he exists outside of time in what is, from the perspective of his subjectivity, the eternal now. Jesus however was born at a particular time and lived his life in time, so to maintain God’s atemporality, we cannot allow predicates that assign temporal properties to Jesus to God, or in particular to God the Father. In general, there are a range of predicates that are true of Jesus that, we want to hold, are not true of God the Father or of the Holy Spirit, and which we would hesitate to ascribe to God simpliciter insofar as they appear to be inconsistent with essential features of divinity.

To avoid the migration of Jesus’ predicates to other Persons of the Trinity, we need to create enough logical space between the Persons to block inferences from claims about Jesus to claims about the Father so that, in general, “Jesus Fs” does not entail “God the Father Fs” where “x Fs” says either that x has a property, is a certain kind of thing or does a certain kind of action. The trouble with Monarchian accounts, which make the Trinity “too tight,” is that they obliterate the logical space between the Persons that would block such inferences. Since Monarchians cannot use Trinitarian doctrine to block these inferences they use Christology to do the job—by either adopting very high Christologies or very low ones.  The wedge has to be driven somewhere and, if there isn’t enough logical space to drive it in between the First and Second Persons of the Trinity, it has to go in between the Second Person, the divine Logos which is from the beginning with God and is God, and whatever it is that is the subject of Jesus predicates.

One way to do this is via an ultra-high Christology according to which the troublesome Jesus predicates aren’t literally true of Christ the divine Logos but are true of something else—the human body he animates, a mere appearance or an imposter. To see how this works, consider Apollarianism, an ultra-high Christology rejected at the Council of Constantinople in 381 and again at the Council of Chalcedon in 451 at which Christological doctrine was formulated. According to this heterodox view, the historical Jesus was a human being who had the Logos plugged into the place that would normally be occupied by a human rational soul. Christ is the Logos and, insofar we ascribe such Jesus predicates as “___ suffered under Pontius Pilate,” “___ was crucified,” “___ died” and “___ was buried” that is merely a façon de parler. Strictly speaking, what these predicates are true of is not Christ but only of the body he used for a time to conduct his worldly operations. Consequently, they do not pass to the Logos or to other Persons of the Trinity, so there is no problem.

The other way to drive the wedge between the Father and the bearer of Jesus predicates is by adopting an ultra-low Christology, that is, by kicking Christ out of the Godhead altogether. Historically, this is the tack taken by Adoptionists who held that the man Jesus became “Son of God” only by adoption and grace dispensed at by God at his baptism, and the view held by contemporary quasi-Christians who deny the divinity of Christ. If Christ, the bearer of Jesus predicates is not divine, problematic Jesus predicates do not pass to the Father, or to God simpliciter, so there is no problem.

Interestingly, Christians have historically rejected ultra-high Christologies on the grounds that they undermine soteriology. This concern was articulated by Gregory of Nazianzus in his critique of Apollinarianism by the dictum “non assumptus, non salus.” The idea is that God’s aim in becoming incarnate was to assume human nature in order to heal it—if Christ only seemed to be human that could not be accomplished. And if he only took on a human body and its vegetative and animal souls—the principles responsible for life, growth, locomotion and emotion—but not the rational soul of a human being, he would have left out the very component of humanness that was in need of healing, since it was precisely man’s rational nature that was corrupted by sin. Anselm makes the same point in Cur Deus Homo? Whatever we think of this sort of argument it was for this reason that Christians worried about Christologies that failed to recognize the full humanity of Christ.

Christians who could not accept either ultra-high or ultra-low Christologies attempted to circumvent the Jesus Predicate Problem by rejecting the ultra-tight Monarchian view of the Trinity. So, writing more than a century before Nicea, Hippolytus suggested that Hereclitean contradictions could be avoided by a Trinitarian doctrine that created enough logical space between the Persons to block inferences from the character of Christ, the Second Person of the Trinity, to claims about the character of the other Persons, the Father in particular. With sufficient logical space between the Persons, Christ’s vincibility, mortality and other properties that are prima facie incompatible with divinity or unworthy of a deity can be segregated so that they don’t transfer to the Father. Given a Subordinationist account on the descending model according to which the Second Person is a semi-divine mediating figure there is no problem assigning troublesome Jesus predicates to him.

The trouble is that once committed to the Nicene doctrine that Christ is wholly divine, consubstantial with and equal to the Father, “God of God, Light of Light, very God of very God,” the same problem arises all over again for the Second Person of the Trinity! If ascribing these properties to the Father is bad, ascribing them to the Son thus understood is just as bad. Historically, the Church’s way with Jesus predicate problems that threaten the doctrine of the Trinity has been to recharacterize them as Christological problems concerning the relation between Christ’s divine and human natures—which are beyond the scope of this essay.

We may ask however whether, once the Church’s Trinity theologians circumvent the Jesus Predicate Problem by passing the buck to the Christologists, there is any reason to worry about Modalism or other tight-Trinity doctrines that minimize the logical space between Persons. As we have seen, historically, the rationale for rejecting Sabellianism was the worry that it did not leave enough space to drive a wedge between Father and Son that would block inferences from “Jesus Fs” to “God the Father Fs.” If however we can contrive a theological account that blocks such inferences Christologically, by driving the wedge between the bearer of Jesus predicates and the Second Person of the Trinity—by, e.g. distinguishing between Christ’s divine and human natures or between Christ qua human and Christ qua God—then there is no particular reason to worry about the space between Trinitarian Persons, and so it may be that Sabellianism is a more attractive proposition than it was initially through to be.

3. Philosophical Puzzles and Solutions

For Christians, at least in the West, Quincunque Vult, commonly known as the Athanasian Creed, defines Trinitarian orthodoxy as follows:

We worship one God in Trinity, and Trinity in Unity, neither confounding the Persons, nor dividing the Substance
For there is one Person of the Father, another of the Son, and another of the Holy Ghost…
Such as the Father is, such is the Son, and such is the Holy Ghost…
[T]he Father is God, the Son is God, and the Holy Ghost is God.
And yet they are not three Gods, but one God

Christians are thus committed to the following claims:

(1) The Father is God

(2) The Son is God

(3) The Holy Spirit is God

(4) The Father is not the Son

(5) The Father is not the Holy Spirit

(6) The Son is not the Holy Spirit

(7) There is exactly one God

a. Trinity and Identity

Can one consistently believe (1) – (7)? It depends on how we read the “is” in (1) – (6). If we read it throughout as the “is” of strict identity, as “=” the answer is no. Identity is an equivalence relation: it is reflexive, symmetric and transitive, which is to say, for all x, y and z the following hold:

Reflexivity:           x = x

Symmetry:            If x = y then y = x

Transitivity:          If x = y and y = z then x = y

In addition, identity is an unrestricted indiscernibilty relation for all properties, which is to say it obeys Leibniz’ Law, understood as the Indiscernibility of Identicals:

LL:                         If x = y then for all properties, P, x has P if and only if y has P

This is bad news. Suppose we read the “is” as “=” in (1) – (6). Then it follows from (1) and (2), by symmetry and transitivity, that the Father is the Son, which contradicts (4). Put another way, given LL, (1) entails that God has all the same properties as the Father, including the property of being identical with the Father insofar as everything has the property of self-identity. (2) says that the Son likewise has all the same properties as God. It follows that, since God has the property of being identical with the Son, the Son also has the property of being identical with the Father, which contradicts (4).

These formal features of identity are non-negotiable in the way that the four-sidedness of squares is: God cannot evade them any more than he can make a square with only three sides. God can make triangles—and pentagons, chiliagons or figures with any number of sides he pleases—but he cannot make such things squares. So, assuming that “God,” “Father,” “Son” and “Holy Spirit” don’t change their reference, the “is” that figures in (1) – (6) cannot be the “is” of strict identity.

b. The “Is” of Predication

In English, most of the time the word “is” occurs it does not express an identity. The “is” that occurs in (8) and (9) is the “is” of predication: it is used to ascribe a property to an object:

(8) Ducati is a dog.

(9) Ducati is canine.

(8) is not an identity statement because “a dog” does not pick out a particular object. Identity is a relation between objects; in particular, it is the relation that everything bears to itself and to no other thing. In a true identity statement the nouns or noun phrases on either sides of the identity pick out the very same thing. (10) and (11) are true identity statements:

(10) Ducati is the chocolate Lab at 613 Second Avenue.

(11) Ducati is Britynic Cadbury of Bourneville

“The chocolate Lab at 613 Second Avenue” and “Britynic Cadbury of Bourneville” each pick out particular dog, as it happens, the same dog that “Ducati” picks out but “a dog” does not. (8) in fact says the same thing as (9)—it says that Ducati has the property of being a dog, that is the property of being canine. The “is” in (8), like the “is” in (9) is therefore, the “is” of predication.

Now consider (1) – (3) understanding the “is” that occurs in each sentence as the “is” of predication to yield:

(1′) The Father is a God

(2′) The Son is a God

(3′) The Holy Spirit is a God

The “is” of predication does not express an equivalence relation and, in general, “x has P” and “y has P” do not imply “x is identical to y.” Ducati is a dog and Riley is a dog but it does not follow that Ducati is (identical to) Riley—in fact they are not. Similarly, (1′) and (2′) do not imply that the Father is the Son so there is no contradiction.

However, (1′) – (3′) just say that the Father, Son and Holy Spirit are each divine, in the way that (8) just says that Ducati is canine, and this leaves open the possibility that there are two, or three Gods involved. They do not explain what makes the Persons one God or provide any rationale for (7). Furthermore, together with (4) – (6) it seems to follow that there are indeed three Gods, just as it follows from “Ducati is a dog,” “Riley is a dog” and “Ducati is not Riley” that there are (at least) two dogs.

This is the concern Gregory of Nyssa addressed in his response to Ablabius, who worried that understanding the unity of Trinitarian persons in terms of their sharing the property of divinity implied Tri-theism:

The argument which you state is something like this: Peter, James, and John, being in one human nature, are called three men: and there is no absurdity in describing those who are united in nature, if they are more than one, by the plural number of the name derived from their nature. If, then, in the above case, custom admits this, and no one forbids us to speak of those who are two as two, or those who are more than two as three, how is it that in the case of our statements of the mysteries of the Faith, though confessing the Three Persons, and acknowledging no difference of nature between them, we are in some sense at variance with our confession, when we say that the Godhead of the Father and of the Son and of the Holy Ghost is one, and yet forbid men to say “there are three Gods”? The question is, as I said, very difficult to deal with. (Gregory of Nyssa, “To Ablabius”)

This is a difficult question indeed.

c. Divine Stuff: ‘God’ as a Mass Term

Gregory proposed the following analogy by way of a solution:

That which is not thus circumscribed is not enumerated, and that which is not enumerated cannot be contemplated in multitude. For we say that gold, even though it be cut into many figures, is one, and is so spoken of, but we speak of many coins or many staters, without finding any multiplication of the nature of gold by the number of staters; and for this reason we speak of gold, when it is contemplated in greater bulk, either in plate or in coin, as “much,” but we do not speak of it as “many golds” on account of the multitude of the material,-except when one says there are “many gold pieces” (Darics, for instance, or staters), in which case it is not the material, but the pieces of money to which the significance of number applies: indeed, properly, we should not call them “gold” but “golden.” As, then, the golden staters are many, but the gold is one, so too those who are exhibited to us severally in the nature of man, as Peter, James, and John, are many, yet the man in them is one. (Gregory of Nyssa. “To Ablabius”)

What Gregory has noticed here is that “gold” is a mass term rather than a count noun. Mass terms have a number of features that distinguish them from count nouns: in particular, they do not take plural, so to that extent as Gregory remarks, “gold…is one.” Intuitively, count nouns designate “things” while mass terms designate “stuffs”—gold, water, oatmeal and the like.

However, Gregory has inferred that human nature and, by analogy, divinity, should be understood as stuff too so that, just as there is one gold, parceled up into bits that are not properly speaking “gold” but merely golden there is just one man parceled up into bits each of which is not, properly speaking, man but merely human.

Richard Cartwright dismisses this solution very quickly as desperate, heretical and unhelpful:

It seems to have been left to Gregory of Nyssa, Basil’s younger brother, to notice that, thus understood, consubstantiality of the Father, the Son, and the Holy Spirit appears to license saying that there are three Gods.  Gregory himself rather desperately suggested that strictly speaking there is only one man. But besides being itself heretical, the suggestion is of no help. (Richard Cartwright. “On the Logical Problem of the Trinity” in Richard Cartwright, Philosophical Essays. MIT Press, 1987. P. 171)

Nevertheless, it may be possible to push a little further along this line. Even though, intuitively, we think of mass nouns as designating more or less homogeneous stuffs, without perceptible, discrete but continuous parts, mass noun is a grammatical category and does not determine the character of what it designates but how we talk about it. The designata of some mass nouns have quite large, readily perceptible discrete parts. Consider “fruit” which, in English typically functions as a mass noun: the plural form, “fruits” is not ill-formed but it is rare and occurs primarily in idioms like “by their fruits ye shall know them”; we say “a lot of fruit” but only rarely “a few fruits” or “many fruits.” Perhaps most tellingly “fruit” takes what are called “sortalizing auxiliary nouns,” devices that attach to mass terms to yield noun phrases that behave like +count nouns: so we talk about “bodies of water,” “piles of sand” and, tellingly, “pieces of fruit.” From the grammatical point of view, Gregory’s revisionary proposal is in order: we can by an act of linguistic legislation decide to treat, perhaps for convenience, “human” as a mass term designating a spatially extended but gappy object, so that Peter, James and John are not, properly speaking, humans but rather pieces of humanity, a stuff which consists of Peter, James, John and all their fellows pooled together.

Perhaps the Trinity can be fixed by an account along the lines of Gregory’s proposal, according to which we may understand the God as a concrete but non-spatio-temporal whole, whose simple, non-spatio-temporal parts are the Trinitarian Persons. If so, then noting that parts need not be spatio-temporal, we might reconstruct (1) – (7) as follows:

(1”) The Father is a part of God

(2”) The Son is a part of God

(3”) The Holy Spirit is a part of God

(4”) The Father is not the same part of God as the Son

(5”) The Father is not the same part of God as the Holy Spirit

(6”) The Son is not the same part of God as the Holy Spirit

(7) There is exactly one God

(1”) – (7) are clearly consistent. Moreover if we remember that “God” is being treated as a mass term, designating all the divinity there is, in the way that “water” designates all the world’s water, of which lakes, rivers and puddles are parts, there is no difficulty in holding that the Persons are equally divine. Every body of water however small is thoroughly H2O: the humblest puddle is as watery as the Pacific Ocean and so, to that extent, water is wholly present in each of its parts. Similarly we can say that each Person is thoroughly God: divinity is wholly present in each of its (non-spatio-temporal) parts.

d. Relative Identity

Gregory’s proposal has not received widespread attention. However a comparable proposal, viz. that the “is” in (1) to (6) be construed as designating relative identity relations, has been widely discussed and solutions to the Trinity puzzle that make this move have been proposed by Peter Geach and more recently by Peter Van Inwagen.

According to Geach, identity statements of the form “x is identical with y” are incomplete: they are elliptical for “x is the same F as y” where F is a sortal term, that is a count noun that conveys criteria of identity. So common nouns like “table,” “man,” and “set” are sortals: grammatically they are count nouns and semantically they, in effect, provide instructions about how to identify them, how to chop out the hunk of the world they fill, how to distinguish them from other objects and how to trace their histories to determine when (if ever) they come into being and when (if ever) they cease to exist. Defenders of the relative identity thesis suggest that we cannot obey the instruction to “count all the things in this room” because “thing” does not convey identity criteria. If I am to count things, I need to know what sorts of things should I count? If I am asked whether this is the same as that, before I can answer I have to ask, “The same what?”

Geach notes further that, where F and G are sortals, it is possible to have cases where some x and y are the same F but not the same G. So, for example, we may want to say that 2/3 is the same rational number as 4/6 but not the same ordered pair of integers or that two copies of Ulysses are the same literary work but not the same book.

Finally, sortal-relative-identity relations are equivalence relations but they are not indiscernibility relations for all properties unrestrictedly. For any sortal-relative-identity relation, being-the-same-F-as, there is a set of predicates, SF, the indiscernibility set for F, such that for any predicate P Î SF, if x is the same F as y then x has P if and only if y has P. For predicates P* Ï SF the inferences from x is the same F as y and x has P* to y has P* and vice versa do not go through.

Now as regards the Trinity puzzle we note that “god” and “person” are sortals and hence that given Geach’s suggestion the following claims are consistent:

(1­R) The Father is the same god as God

(2R) The Son is the same god as God

(3R) The Holy Spirit is the same god as God

(4R) The Father is not the same divine person as the Son

(5R) The Father is not the same divine person as the Holy Spirit

(6R) The Son is not the same divine person as the Holy Spirit

The relative identity account of Trinitarian claims is similar to the reconstruction of Trinitarian claims in (1”) – (6”) insofar as rely on the strategy of invoking different relations in the first and last three statements: the relations of being-part-of-the-same-whole-as and being-the-same-part-as are different to one another as are the relations of being-the-same-god-as and being-the-same-divine-person-as. Consequently, (1R) – (6R) are consistent with (7). Sortals, as noted, provide rules for counting. Counting by book, two copies of Ulysses count as two; counting by literary work, they count as one. Similarly, the suggestion is that counting by divine person, the Father, Son and Holy Spirit count as three but counting by god they count as one and so we can affirm (7): there is exactly one God. The relative identity strategy thus avoids Tri-theism.

The relative identity strategy also circumvents the Jesus Predicate Problem, at least to the extent that we want to block inferences from “The Son Fs” to “The Father Fs” for a range of predicates including “became incarnate,” “was crucified,” “suffered under Pontius Pilate” and the like. To block objectionable inferences we note that these predicates do not fall within the indiscernibility set for divine person and so the relative identity strategy avoids Patripassionism.

In addition, on this account, we can explain why (1R) – (3R) entail that the Father, Son and Holy Spirit each have those properties that are constituitive of full divinity. We note that “is omnipotent,” “is omniscient,” “is omnibenevolent” and other generically divine properties are in the indiscernibillity set for god so that given God has the properties they designate we may infer that the same is true of the Father, Son and Holy Spirit. Intuitively, there are generically divine properties, designated by predicates in the indiscernibility set for for god, which all Trinitarian Persons have in virtue of (1R) – (3R) and there are hypostatic properties which each Person has in virtue of being the Person he is.

Relative identity is however a controversial doctrine in its own right and, even if we accept the metaphysical baggage it carries, may not suitable for theological purposes. So Michael Rae worries that relative identity commits one to a theologically disastrous antirealistism:

Many philosophers are attracted to antirealism, but accepting it as part of a solution to the problem of the Trinity is disastrous.  For clearly orthodoxy will not permit us to say that the very existence of Father, Son, and Holy Spirit is a theory-dependent matter.  Nor will it permit us to say that the distinctness of the divine Persons is somehow relative to our ways of thinking or theorizing. The latter appears to be a form of modalism. And yet it is hard to see how it could be otherwise if Geach’s theory of relative identity is true. For what else could it possibly mean to say that there is simply no fact about whether Father, Son, and Holy Spirit are the same thing as one another, the same thing as God, or, indeed, the same thing as Baal. (Michael Rae, “Relative Identity and the Doctrine of the Trinity,” Philosophia Christi vol. 5, No. 2)

e. The Trinity and Other Identity Puzzles

The logical problem of the Trinity arises because, as we have seen in 3.a, (1) – (7) are inconsistent if the “is” that figures in them is interpreted as the “is” of (absolute) identity. In this respect, the Trinity puzzle is comparable to a range of puzzles concerning the identity of ordinary material objects.

One range of such puzzles concerns the problem of material composition. A lump of clay is made into a statue. The statue and the lump occupy exactly the same spatial region so we want to say that they are they are the same thing and that there is just one material object in the region “they” occupy: we balk at the idea of more than one material object occupying exactly the same place. But the statue and the clay do not have all the same properties: the statue was formed by the sculptor but the lump was not; the lump can survive the most radical changes in shape, including changes that would transform it into a different statue but the statue cannot. Consequently we cannot hold that there is a statue and a lump of clay and that they are strictly identical without falling afoul of Leibniz’ Law. We want to say that the statue and clay count as one material object but we are barred from holding that they are strictly identical. In this respect the problem of material composition poses the same problem as the Trinity doctrine: we want to say the Persons are one God but we are barred, in this case by theological concerns, from saying that they are strictly identical.

The problem posed by the material composition and other identity puzzles, including the Ship of Theseus and the problem of the dividing self which figures in discussions of personal identity, is that there are a great many cases where we want to say that objects x and y are the same thing but where the relation between x and y is such that it violates the formal features of identity—either because it is one-many rather than one-one or because it is not an unrestricted indiscernibility relation. And this is precisely the problem posed by the doctrine of the Trinity.

It was noted above that the proposal in 3.b, that the “is” in (1) – (3) should be interpreted as the “is” of predication, is also unacceptable because it is tri-theistic. It was also noted that the accounts suggested in 3.c and 3.d are not overtly incoherent but ultimately depend respectively on whether a mereology and an account of relative are workable. The relative identity account has been discussed extensively in the literature. The worry about the relative identity account is not that it fails to produce the right results as regards the doctrine of the Trinity, but that relative identity is itself a questionable business and in any case carries metaphysical baggage that may be theologically unacceptable.

The moral of this story should perhaps be that “identity,” as Frege famously remarked, “gives rise to challenging questions which are not altogether easy to answer” (Gottlob Frege, “On Sense and Reference”). For all that critics have ridiculed the doctrine of the Trinity as a prime example of the absurdity of Christian doctrine—as the late Bishop Pike did when he suggested that the Trinity was “a sort of committee god”—Trinity talk is no worse off than much non-theological talk about the identities of non-divine persons and ordinary material objects.

4. References and Further Readings

  • Augustine. “On the Trinity.” The Early Church Fathers. Christian Classics Ethereal Library.
  • Baber, H. E. “Sabellianism Reconsidered.” in Sophia vol. 41, No. 2 (October 2002): 1-18.
  • Baber, H. E. “Trinity, Filioque and Semantic Ascent” forthcoming in Sophia.
  • Bobrinskoy, Boris. The Mystery of the Trinity. Crestwood, NY: St. Vladimir’s Seminary press, 1999.
  • Brower, Jeffrey E. and Michael C. Rea. “Material Constitution and the Trinity.” Faith and Philosophy 22 (2005): 57-76.
  • Brown, David. The Divine Trinity. London: Duckworth, 1985.
  • Cartwright, Richard. “On the Logical Problem of the Trinity.” In Philosophical Essays. The MIT Press, 1990.
  • Davis, Stephen T., Kendall, Daniel, S.J., and O’Collins, Gerald, S.J., eds. The Trinity. An Interdisciplinary Symposium on the Trinity. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1999.
  • Gregory of Nyssa. “To Ablabius.” The Early Church Fathers. Christian Classics Ethereal Library.
  • Hebblethwaite, Brian. Philosophical Theology and Christian Doctrine. Oxford: Blackwell Publishing Ltd, 2005. Esp. Ch. 5: “Trinity.”
  • Hippolytus, Against All Heresies, Book IX, The Early Church Fathers. Christian Classics Ethereal Library.
  • Leftow, Brian. “Anti Social Trinitarianism.” In The Trinity: An Interdisciplinary Symposium on the Trinity.  Feenstra, R. J. and Plantinga, C. Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press, 1989.
  • Peters, Ted. God as Trinity. Louisville, KY: Westminster/John Knox Press, 1993.
  • Photios, Patriarch of Constantinople. On the Mystagogy of the Holy Spirit. Astoria, NY: Studion Publishers, Inc., 1983.
  • Rea, Michael C. “Relative Identity and the Doctrine of the Trinity.” In Philosophic Christi vol. 5, No. 2 (2003): 431-445.
  • Rusch, William G., ed. The Trinitarian Controversy. Philadelphia: Fortress Press, 1980.
  • Stead, C. Divine Substance. Oxford: The Clarendon Press, 1977.
  • Studer, Basil. Trinity and Incarnation. Collegeville, MN: The Liturgical Press, 1993.
  • Swinburne, Richard. The Christian God. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1994.
  • Van Inwagen, Peter. “And yet there are not three Gods but one God.” In Philosophy and the Christian Faith, ed. T. V. Morris. Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press, 1988.
  • Yandell, K. E. “The most brutal and inexcusable error in counting?” Trinity and consistency.  Religious Studies 30 (1994): 201-17.

Author Information

H.E. Baber
Email: baber@usd.edu
University of San Diego
U. S. A.

The Indispensability Argument in the Philosophy of Mathematics

In his seminal 1973 paper, “Mathematical Truth,” Paul Benacerraf presented a problem facing all accounts of mathematical truth and knowledge.  Standard readings of mathematical claims entail the existence of mathematical objects. But, our best epistemic theories seem to deny that knowledge of mathematical objects is possible. Thus, the philosopher of mathematics faces a dilemma: either abandon standard readings of mathematical claims or give up our best epistemic theories.  Neither option is attractive.

The indispensability argument in the philosophy of mathematics is an attempt to avoid Benacerraf’s dilemma by showing that our best epistemology is consistent with standard readings of mathematical claims.  Broadly speaking, it is an attempt to justify knowledge of an abstract mathematical ontology using only a strictly empiricist epistemology.

The indispensability argument in the philosophy of mathematics, in its most general form, consists of two premises.  The major premise states that we should believe that mathematical objects exist if we need them in our best scientific theory.  The minor premise claims that we do in fact require mathematical objects in our scientific theory.  The argument concludes that we should believe in the abstract objects of mathematics.

This article begins with a general overview of the problem of justifying our mathematical beliefs that motivates the indispensability argument.  The most prominent proponents of the indispensability argument have been W.V. Quine and Hilary Putnam.  The second section of the article discusses a reconstruction of Quine’s argument in detail.  Quine’s argument depends on his general procedure for determining a best theory and its ontic commitments, and on his confirmation holism.  The third and fourth sections of the article discuss versions of the indispensability argument which do not depend on Quine’s method: one from Putnam and one from Michael Resnik.

The relationship between constructing a best theory and producing scientific explanations has recently become a salient topic in discussions of the indispensability argument.  The fifth section of the article discusses a newer version of the indispensability argument, the explanatory indispensability argument.  The last four sections of the article are devoted to a general characterization of indispensability arguments over various versions, a brief discussion of the most prominent responses to the indispensability argument, a distinction between inter- and intra-theoretic indispensability arguments, and a short conclusion.

Table of Contents

  1. The Problem of Beliefs About Mathematical Objects
  2. Quine’s Indispensability Argument
    1. A Best Theory
    2. Believing Our Best Theory
    3. Quine’s Procedure for Determining Ontic Commitments
    4. Mathematization
  3. Putnam’s Success Argument
  4. Resnik’s Pragmatic Indispensability Argument
  5. The Explanatory Indispensability Argument
  6. Characteristics of Indispensability Arguments in the Philosophy of Mathematics
  7. Responses to the Indispensability Argument
  8. Inter-theoretic and Intra-theoretic Indispensability Arguments
  9. Conclusion
  10. References and Further Reading

1. The Problem of Beliefs About Mathematical Objects

Most of us have a lot of mathematical beliefs. For example, we might believe that the tangent to a circle intersects the radius of that circle at right angles, that the square root of two can not be expressed as the ratio of two integers, and that the set of all subsets of a given set has more elements than the given set. Most of us also believe that those claims refer to mathematical objects such as circles, integers, and sets. Regarding all these mathematical beliefs, the fundamental question motivating the indispensability argument is, “How can we justify our mathematical beliefs?”

Mathematical objects are in many ways unlike ordinary physical objects such as trees and cars. We learn about ordinary objects, at least in part, by using our senses. It is not obvious that we learn about mathematical objects this way. Indeed, it is difficult to see how we could use our senses to learn about mathematical objects. We do not see integers, or hold sets. Even geometric figures are not the kinds of things that we can sense. Consider any point in space; call it P. P is only a point, too small for us to see, or otherwise sense. Now imagine a precise fixed distance away from P, say an inch and a half. The collection of all points that are exactly an inch and a half away from P is a sphere. The points on the sphere are, like P, too small to sense. We have no sense experience of the geometric sphere. If we tried to approximate the sphere with a physical object, say by holding up a ball with a three-inch diameter, some points on the edge of the ball would be slightly further than an inch and a half away from P, and some would be slightly closer. The sphere is a mathematically precise object. The ball is rough around the edges. In order to mark the differences between ordinary objects and mathematical objects, we often call mathematical objects “abstract objects.”

When we study geometry, the theorems we prove apply directly and exactly to mathematical objects, like our sphere, and only indirectly and approximately to physical objects, like our ball. Numbers, too, are insensible. While we might see or touch a bowl of precisely eighteen grapes, we see and taste the grapes, not the eighteen. We can see a numeral, “18,” but that is the name for a number, just as the term “Russell” is my name and not me. We can sense the elements of some sets, but not the sets themselves. And some sets are sets of sets, abstract collections of abstract objects. Mathematical objects are not the kinds of things that we can see or touch, or smell, taste or hear. If we can not learn about mathematical objects by using our senses, a serious worry arises about how we can justify our mathematical beliefs.

The question of how we can justify our beliefs about mathematical objects has long puzzled philosophers. One obvious way to try to answer our question is to appeal to the fact that we prove the theorems of mathematics. But, appealing to mathematical proofs will not solve the problem. Mathematical proofs are ordinarily construed as derivations from fundamental axioms. These axioms, such as the Zermelo-Frankel axioms for set theory, the Peano Axioms for number theory, or the more-familiar Euclidean axioms for geometry, refer to the same kinds of mathematical objects. Our question remains about how we justify our beliefs in the axioms.

For simplicity, to consider our question of how we can justify our beliefs about mathematical objects, we will only consider sets. Set theory is generally considered the most fundamental mathematical theory. All statements of number theory, including those concerning real numbers, can be written in the language of set theory. Through the method of analysis, all geometric theorems can be written as algebraic statements, where geometric points are represented by real numbers. Claims from all other areas of mathematics can be written in the language of set theory, too.

Sets are abstract objects, lacking any spatio-temporal location. Their existence is not contingent on our existence. They lack causal efficacy. Our question, then, given that we lack sense experience of sets, is how we can justify our beliefs about sets and set theory.

There are a variety of distinct answers to our question. Some philosophers, called rationalists, claim that we have a special, non-sensory capacity for understanding mathematical truths, a rational insight arising from pure thought. But, the rationalist’s claims appear incompatible with an understanding of human beings as physical creatures whose capacities for learning are exhausted by our physical bodies. Other philosophers, called logicists, argue that mathematical truths are just complex logical truths. In the late nineteenth and early twentieth centuries, the logicists Gottlob Frege, Alfred North Whitehead, and Bertrand Russell attempted to reduce all of mathematics to obvious statements of logic, for example, that every object is identical to itself, or that if p then p. But, it turns out that we can not reduce mathematics to logic without adding substantial portions of set theory to our logic. A third group of philosophers, called nominalists or fictionalists, deny that there are any mathematical objects; if there are no mathematical objects, we need not justify our beliefs about them.

The indispensability argument in the philosophy of mathematics is an attempt to justify our mathematical beliefs about abstract objects, while avoiding any appeal to rational insight. Its most significant proponent was Willard van Orman Quine.

2. Quine’s Indispensability Argument

Though Quine alludes to an indispensability argument in many places, he never presented a detailed formulation. For a selection of such allusions, see Quine 1939, 1948, 1951, 1955, 1958, 1960, 1978, and 1986a. This articles discusses the following version of the argument:

QI: QI1. We should believe the theory which best accounts for our sense experience.
QI2. If we believe a theory, we must believe in its ontic commitments.
QI3. The ontic commitments of any theory are the objects over which that theory first-order quantifies.
QI4. The theory which best accounts for our sense experience first-order quantifies over mathematical objects.
QIC. We should believe that mathematical objects exist.

An ontic commitment to object o is a commitment to believing that o exists. First-order quantification is quantification in standard predicate logic. One presumption behind QI is that the theory which best accounts for our sense experience is our best scientific theory. Thus, Quine naturally defers much of the work of determining what exists to scientists. While it is obvious that scientists use mathematics in developing their theories, it is not obvious why the uses of mathematics in science should lead us to believe in the existence of abstract objects. For example, when we study the interactions of charged particles, we rely on Coulomb’s Law, which states that the electromagnetic force F between two charged particles 1 and 2  is proportional to the charges q1 and q2 on the particles and, inversely, to the distance r between them.

CL:    F = k ∣q1q2∣/ r2 ,   where the electrostatic constant k ≈ 9 x 109 Nm2/c2

∣q1q2∣ is the absolute value of the product of the two charges. Notice that CL refers to a real number, k, and employs mathematical functions such as multiplication and absolute value. Still, we use Coulomb’s Law to study charged particles, not to study mathematical objects, which have no effect on those particles. The plausibility of Quine’s indispensability argument thus depends on both (i) Quine’s claim that the evidence for our scientific theories transfers to the mathematical elements of those theories, which is implicit in QI1, and (ii) his method for determining the ontic commitments of our theories at QI3 and QI4. The method underlying Quine’s argument involves gathering our physical laws and writing them in a canonical language of first-order logic. The commitments of this formal theory may be found by examining its quantifications.

The remainder of this section discusses each of the premises of QI in turn.

a. A Best Theory

The first premise of QI is that we should believe the theory which best accounts for our sense experience, that is, we should believe our best scientific theory.

Quine’s belief that we should defer all questions about what exists to natural science is really an expression of what he calls, and has come to be known as, naturalism. He describes naturalism as, “[A]bandonment of the goal of a first philosophy. It sees natural science as an inquiry into reality, fallible and corrigible but not answerable to any supra-scientific tribunal, and not in need of any justification beyond observation and the hypothetico-deductive method” (Quine 1981: 72).

Quine’s naturalism was developed in large part as a response to logical positivism, which is also called logical empiricism or just positivism. Positivism requires that any justified belief be constructed out of, and be reducible to, claims about observable phenomena. We know about ordinary objects like trees because we have sense experience, or sense data, of trees directly. We know about very small or very distant objects, despite having no direct sense experience of them, by having sense data of their effects, say electron trails in a cloud chamber. For the positivists, any scientific claim must be reducible to sense data.

Instead of starting with sense data and reconstructing a world of trees and persons, Quine assumes that ordinary objects exist. Further, Quine starts with an understanding of natural science as our best account of the sense experience which gives us beliefs about ordinary objects. Traditionally, philosophers believed that it was the job of epistemology to justify our knowledge. In contrast, the central job of Quine’s naturalist is to describe how we construct our best theory, to trace the path from stimulus to science, rather than to justify knowledge of either ordinary objects or scientific theory.

Quine’s rejection of positivism included the insight, now known as confirmation holism, that individual sentences are only confirmed in the context of a broader theory. Confirmation holism arises from an uncontroversial observation that any sentence s can be assimilated without contradiction to any theory T, as long as we adjust truth values of any sentences of T that conflict with s. These adjustments may entail further adjustments, and the new theory may in the end look quite different than it did before we accommodated s. But we can, as a matter of logic, hold on to any sentence come what may. And, we are not forced to hold on to any statement, come what may; there are no unassailable truths.

For a simple example, suppose I have a friend named Abigail. I have a set of beliefs, which we can call a theory of my friendship with her. (A theory is just a collection of sentences.) Suppose that I overhear Abigail saying mean things about me. New evidence conflicts with my old theory. I have a choice whether to reject the evidence (for example, “I must have mis-heard”) or to accommodate the evidence by adjusting my theory, giving up the portions about Abigail being my friend, say, or about my friends not saying mean things about me. Similarly, when new astronomical evidence in the 15th and 16th centuries threatened the old geocentric model of the universe, people were faced with a choice of whether to accept the evidence, giving up beliefs about the Earth being at the center of the universe, or to reject the evidence. Instead of requiring that individual experiences are each independently assessed, confirmation holism entails that there are no justifications for particular claims independent of our entire best theory. We always have various options for restoring an inconsistent theory to consistency.

Confirmation holism entails that our mathematical theories and our scientific theories are linked, and that our justifications for believing in science and mathematics are not independent. When new evidence conflicts with our current scientific theory, we can choose to adjust either scientific principles or mathematical ones. Evidence for the scientific theory is also evidence for the mathematics used in that theory.

The question of how we justify our beliefs about mathematical objects arose mainly because we could not perceive them directly. By rejecting positivism’s requirement for reductions of scientific claims to sense data, Quine allows for beliefs in mathematical objects despite their abstractness. We do not need sensory experience of mathematical objects in order to justify our mathematical beliefs. We just need to show that mathematical objects are indispensable to our best theory.

QI1 may best be seen as a working hypothesis in the spirit of Ockham’s Razor. We look to our most reliable endeavor, natural science, to tell us what there is. We bring to science a preference that it account for our entrenched esteem for ordinary experience. And we posit no more than is necessary for our best scientific theory.

b. Believing Our Best Theory

The second premise of QI states that our belief in a theory naturally extends to the objects which that theory posits.

Against QI.2, one might think that we could believe a theory while remaining agnostic or instrumentalist about whether its objects exist. Physics is full of fictional idealizations, like infinitely long wires, centers of mass, and uniform distributions of charge. Other sciences also posit objects that we do not really think exist, like populations in Hardy-Weinberg equilibrium (biology), perfectly rational consumers (economics), and average families (sociology). We posit such ideal objects to facilitate using a theory. We might believe our theory, while recognizing that the objects to which it refers are only ideal. If we hold this instrumentalist attitude toward average families and infinitely long wires, we might hold it toward circles, numbers and sets, too.

Quine argues that any discrepancy between our belief in a theory and our beliefs in its objects is illegitimate double-talk. One can not believe in only certain elements of a theory which one accepts. If we believe a theory which says that there are centers of mass, then we are committed to those centers of mass. If we believe a theory which says that there are electrons and quarks and other particles too small to see, then we are committed to such particles. If our best theory posits mathematical objects, then we must believe that they exist.

QI1 and QI2 together entail that we should believe in all of the objects that our best theory says exist. Any particular evidence applies to the whole theory, which produces its posits uniformly. Quine thus makes no distinction between justifications of observable and unobservable objects, or between physical and mathematical objects. All objects, trees and electrons and sets, are equally posits of our best theory, to be taken equally seriously. “To call a posit a posit is not to patronize it” (Quine 1960: 22).

There will be conflict between our currently best theory and the better theories that future science will produce. The best theories are, of course, not now available. Yet, what exists does not vary with our best theory. Thus, any current expression of our commitments is at best speculative. We must have some skepticism toward our currently best theory, if only due to an inductive awareness of the transience of such theories.

On the other hand, given Quine’s naturalism, we have no better theory from which to evaluate the posits of our currently best theory. There is no external, meta-scientific perspective. We know, casually and meta-theoretically, that our current theory will be superceded, and that we will give up some of our current beliefs; but we do not know how our theory will be improved, and we do not know which beliefs we will give up. The best we can do is believe the best theory we have, and believe in its posits, and have a bit of humility about these beliefs.

c. Quine’s Procedure for Determining Ontic Commitments

The first two premises of QI entail that we should believe in the posits of our best theory, but they do not specify how to determine precisely what the posits of a theory are. The third premise appeals to Quine’s general procedure for determining the ontic commitments of a theory. Anyone who wishes to know what to believe exists, in particular whether to believe that mathematical objects exist, needs a general method for determining ontic commitment. Rather than relying on brute observations, Quine provides a simple, broadly applicable procedure. First, we choose a best theory. Next, we regiment that theory in first-order logic with identity. Last, we examine the domain of quantification of the theory to see what objects the theory needs to come out as true.

Quine’s method for determining our commitments applies to any theory—theories which refer to trees, electrons and numbers, and theories which refer to ghosts, caloric and God.

We have already discussed how the first step in Quine’s procedure applies to QI. The second step of Quine’s procedure for determining the commitments of a theory refers to first-order logic as a canonical language. Quine credits first-order logic with extensionality, efficiency, elegance, convenience, simplicity, and beauty (Quine 1986: 79 and 87). Quine’s enthusiasm for first-order logic largely derives from various attractive technical virtues. In first-order logic, a variety of definitions of logical truth concur: in terms of logical structure, substitution of sentences or of terms, satisfaction by models, and proof. First-order logic is complete, in the sense that any valid formula is provable. Every consistent first-order theory has a model. First-order logic is compact, which means that any set of first-order axioms will be consistent if every finite subset of that set is consistent. It admits of both upward and downward Löwenheim-Skolem theorems, which mean that every theory which has an infinite model will have a model of every infinite cardinality (upward) and that every theory which has an infinite model of any cardinality will have a denumerable model (downward). (See Mendelson 1997: 377.)

Less technically, the existential quantifier in first-order logic is a natural equivalent of the English term “there is,” and Quine proposes that all existence claims can and should be made by existential sentences of first-order logic. “The doctrine is that all traits of reality worthy of the name can be set down in an idiom of this austere form if in any idiom” (Quine 1960: 228).

We should take first-order logic as our canonical language only if:

A.   We need a single canonical language;

B.   It really is adequate; and

C.   There is no other adequate language.

Condition A arises almost without argument from QI1 and QI2. One of Quine’s most striking and important innovations was his linking of our questions about what exists with our concerns when constructing a canonical formal language. When we regiment our correct scientific theory correctly, Quine argues, we will know what we should believe exists. “The quest of a simplest, clearest overall pattern of canonical notation is not to be distinguished from a quest of ultimate categories, a limning of the most general traits of reality” (Quine 1960: 161).

Whether condition B holds depends on how we use our canonical language. First-order logic is uncontroversially useful for what Quine calls semantic ascent. When we ascend, we talk about words without presuming that they refer to anything; we can deny the existence of objects without seeming to commit to them. For example, on some theories of language sentences which contain terms that do not refer to real things are puzzling. Consider:

CP:     The current president of the United States does not have three children.

TF:     The tooth fairy does not exist.

If CP is to be analyzed as saying that there is a current president who lacks the property of having three children, then by parity of reasoning TF seems to say that there is a tooth fairy that lacks the attribute of existence. This analysis comes close to interpreting the reasonable sentence TF as a contradiction saying that there is something that is not.

In contrast, we can semantically ascend, claiming that the term “the tooth fairy” does not refer. TF is conveniently regimented in first-order logic, using “T” to stand for the property of being the tooth fairy. “‘∼(∃x)Tx” carries with it no implication that the tooth fairy exists. Similar methods can be applied to more serious existence questions, like whether there is dark energy or an even number greater than two which is not the sum of two primes. Thus, first-order logic provides a framework for settling disagreements over existence claims.

Against the supposed adequacy of first-order logic, there are expressions whose first-order logical regimentations are awkward at best. Leibniz’s law, that identical objects share all properties, seems to require a second-order formulation. Similarly, H resists first-order logical treatment.

H:     Some book by every author is referred to in some essay by every critic (Hintikka 1973: 345).

H may be adequately handled by branching quantifiers, which are not elements of first-order logic.

There are other limitations on first-order logic. Regimenting a truth predicate in first-order logic leads naturally to the paradox of the liar. And propositional attitudes, such as belief, create opaque contexts that prevent natural substitutions of identicals otherwise permitted by standard first-order inference rules. Still, defenders of first-order logic have proposed a variety of solutions to these difficulties, many of which may be due not to first-order logic itself but to deeper problems with language.

For condition C, Quine argues that no other language is adequate for canonical purposes. Ordinary language appears to be too sloppy, in large part due to its use of names to refer to objects. We use names to refer to some of the things that exist: “Muhammad Ali,” “Jackie Chan,” “The Eiffel Tower,” But some names, such as “Spiderman,” do not refer to anything real. Some things, such as most insects and pebbles, lack names. Some things, such as most people, have multiple names. We could clean up our language, constructing an artificial version in which everything has exactly one name. Still, in principle, there will not be enough names for all objects. As Cantor’s diagonal argument shows, there are more real numbers than there are available names for those numbers. If we want a language in which to express all and only our commitments, we have to look beyond languages which rely on names.

Given the deficiencies of languages with names and Quine’s argument that the existential quantifier is a natural formal equivalent of “there is,” the only obvious remaining alternatives to first-order logic as a canonical language are higher-order logics. Higher-order logics have all of the expressive powers of first-order logic, and more. Most distinctly, where first-order logic allows variables only in the object position (i.e. following a predicate), second-order logic allows variables in the predicate positions as well, and introduces quantifiers to bind those predicates. Logics of third and higher order allow further predication and quantification. As they raise no significant philosophical worries beyond those concerning second-order logic, this discussion will focus solely on second-order logic.

To see how second-order logic works, consider the inference R.

R: R1. There is a red shirt.
R2. There is a red hat.
RC. So, there is something (redness) that some shirt and some hat share.

RC does not follow from R1 and R2 in first-order logic, but it does follow in second-order logic. If we let Sx mean that x is a shirt, and Px mean that x is a property, and so forth, then we have the following valid second-order inference RS:

RS: R1S. (∃x)(Sx & Rx)
R2S. (∃x)(Hx & Rx)
RCS. (∃P)(∃x)(∃y)(Sx & Hy & Px & Py)

Accommodating inferences such as R by extending one’s logic to second-order might seem useful. But, higher-order logics allow us to infer, as a matter of logic, that there is some thing, presumably the property of redness, that the shirt and the hat share. It is simple common sense that shirts and hats exist. It is a matter of significant philosophical controversy whether properties like redness exist. Thus, a logic which permits an inference like RS is controversial.

Quine’s objection to higher-order logics, and thus his defense of first-order logic, is that we are forced to admit controversial elements as interpretations of predicate variables. Even if we interpret predicate variables in the least controversial way, as sets of objects that have those properties, higher-order logics demand sets. Thus, Quine calls second-order logic, “Set theory in sheep’s clothing” (Quine 1986a: 66). Additionally, higher-order logics lack many of the technical virtues, such as completeness and compactness, of first-order logic. (For a defense of second-order logic, see Shapiro 1991.)

Once we settle on first-order logic as a canonical language, we must specify a method for determining the commitments of a theory in that language. Reading existential claims seems straightforward. For example, R2 says that there is a thing which is a hat, and which is red. But, theories do not determine their own interpretations. Quine relies on standard Tarskian model-theoretic methods to interpret first-order theories. On a Tarskian interpretation, or semantics, we ascend to a metalanguage to construct a domain of quantification for a given theory. We consider whether sequences of objects in the domain, taken as values of the variables bound by the quantifiers, satisfy the theory’s statements, or theorems. The objects in the domain that make the theory come out true are the commitments of the theory. “To be is to be a value of a variable” (Quine 1939: 50) is how Quine summarizes the point. (For an accessible discussion of Tarskian semantics, see Tarski 1944).

Quine’s procedure for determining the commitments of a theory can prevent us from prejudging what exists. We construct scientific theory in the most effective and attractive way we can. We balance formal considerations, like the elegance of the mathematics involved, with an attempt to account for the broadest sensory evidence. The more comprehensive and elegant the theory, the more we are compelled to believe it, even if it tells us that the world is not the way we thought it is. If the theory yields a heliocentric model of the solar system, or the bending of rays of light, then we are committed to heliocentrism or bent light rays. Our commitments are the byproducts of this neutral process.

d. Mathematization

The final step of QI involves simply looking at the domain of the theory we have constructed. When we write our best theory in our first-order language, we discover that the theory includes physical laws which refer to functions, sets, and numbers. Consider again Coulomb’s Law: F = k ∣q1q2∣/ r2. Here is a partial first-order regimentation which suffices to demonstrate the commitments of the law, using ‘Px’ for ‘x is a charged particle’.

CLR:     ∀x∀y{(Px & Py) → ∃f [f(q(x), q(y), d(x,y), k) =  F]}       where F = k ∣q(x) q(y)∣ / d(x,y)2

In addition to the charged particles over which the universal quantifiers in front range, there is an existential quantification over a function, f. This function maps numbers [the Coulomb’s Law constant k, and measurements of charge q(x) and q(y), and distance d] to other numbers (measurements of force F between the particles).

In order to ensure that there are enough sets to construct these numbers and functions, our ideal theory must include set-theoretic axioms, perhaps those of Zermelo-Fraenkel set theory, ZF.

The full theory of ZF is unnecessary for scientific purposes; there will be some sets which are never needed and some numbers which are never used to measure any real quantity. But, we take a full set theory in order to make our larger theory as elegant as possible. We can derive from the axioms of any adequate set theory a vast universe of sets. So, CL contains or entails several existential mathematical claims. According to QI, we should believe that these mathematical objects exist.

Examples such as CLR abound. Real numbers are used for measurement throughout physics, and other sciences. Quantum mechanics makes essential use of Hilbert spaces and probability functions. The theory of relativity invokes the hyperbolic space of Lobachevskian geometry. Economics is full of analytic functions. Psychology uses a wide range of statistics.

Opponents of the indispensability argument have developed sophisticated strategies for re-interpreting apparently ineliminable uses of mathematics, especially in physics. Some reinterpretations use alethic modalities (necessity and possibility) to replace mathematical objects. Others replace numbers with space-time points or regions. It is quite easy, but technical, to rewrite first-order theories in order to avoid quantifying over mathematical objects. It is less easy to do so while maintaining Quine’s canonical language of first-order logic.

For example, Hartry Field’s reformulation of Newtonian gravitational theory (Field 1980; discussed below in section 7) replaces the real numbers which are ordinarily used to measure fundamental properties such as mass and momentum with relations among regions of space-time. Field replaces the “2” in the claim “The beryllium sphere has a mass of 2 kg” with a ratio of space-time regions, one twice as long as the other. In order to construct the proper ratios of space-time regions, and having no mathematical axioms at his disposal, Field’s project requires either second-order logic or axioms of mereology, both of which are controversial extensions of first-order logic. For an excellent survey of dispensabilist strategies, and further references, see Burgess and Rosen 1997; for more recent work, see Melia 1998 and Melia 2000.

Quine’s indispensability argument depends on controversial claims about believing in a single best theory, finding our commitments by using a canonical first-order logic, and the ineliminability of mathematics from scientific theories. Other versions of the argument attempt to avoid some of these controversial claims.

3. Putnam’s Success Argument

In his early work, Hilary Putnam accepted Quine’s version of the indispensability argument, but he eventually differed with Quine on a variety of questions. Most relevantly, Putnam abandoned Quine’s commitment to a single, regimented, best theory; and he urged that realism in mathematics can be justified by its indispensability for correspondence notions of truth (which require set-theoretic relations) and for formal logic, especially for metalogical notions like derivability and validity which are ordinarily treated set-theoretically.

The position Putnam calls realism in mathematics is ambiguous between two compatible views. Sentence realism is the claim that sentences of mathematics can be true or false. Object realism is the claim that mathematical objects exist. Most object realists are sentence realists, though some sentence realists, including some structuralists, deny object realism. Indispensability arguments may be taken to establish either sentence realism or object realism. Quine was an object realist. Michael Resnik presents an indispensability argument for sentence realism; see section 4. This article takes Putnam’s realism to be both object and sentence realism, but nothing said below depends on that claim.

Realism contrasts most obviously with fictionalism, on which there are no mathematical objects, and many mathematical sentences considered to be true by the realist are taken to be false. To understand the contrast between realism and fictionalism, consider the following two paradigm mathematical claims, the first existential and the second conditional.

E:   There is a prime number greater than any you have ever thought of.

C:   The consecutive angles of any parallelogram are supplementary.

The fictionalist claims that mathematical existence claims like E are false since prime numbers are numbers and there are no numbers. The standard conditional interpretation of C is that if any two angles are consecutive in a parallelogram, then they are supplementary. If there are no mathematical objects, then standard truth-table semantics for the material conditional entail that C, having a false antecedent, is true. The fictionalist claims that conditional statements which refer to mathematical objects, such as C, are only vacuously true, if true.

Putnam’s non-Quinean indispensability argument, the success argument, is a defense of realism over fictionalism, and other anti-realist positions. The success argument emphasizes the success of science, rather than the construction and interpretation of a best theory.

PS: PS1. Mathematics succeeds as the language of science.
PS2. There must be a reason for the success of mathematics as the language of science.
PS3. No positions other than realism in mathematics provide a reason.
PSC. So, realism in mathematics must be correct.

Putnam’s success argument for mathematics is analogous to his success argument for scientific realism. The scientific success argument relies on the claim that any position other than realism makes the success of science miraculous. The mathematical success argument claims that the success of mathematics can only be explained by a realist attitude toward its theorems and objects. “I believe that the positive argument for realism [in science] has an analogue in the case of mathematical realism. Here too, I believe, realism is the only philosophy that doesn’t make the success of the science a miracle” (Putnam 1975a: 73).

One potential criticism of any indispensability argument is that by making the justification of our mathematical beliefs depend on our justification for believing in science, our mathematical beliefs become only as strong as our confidence in science. It is notoriously difficult to establish the truth of scientific theory. Some philosophers, such as Nancy Cartwright and Bas van Fraassen, have argued that science, or much of it, is false, in part due to idealizations. (See Cartwright 1983 and van Fraassen 1980.) The success of science may be explained by its usefulness, without presuming that scientific theories are true.

Still, even if science were only useful rather than true, PS claims that our mathematical beliefs may be justified by the uses of mathematics in science. The problems with scientific realism focus on the incompleteness and error of contemporary scientific theory. These problems need not infect our beliefs in the mathematics used in science. A tool may work fine, even on a broken machine. One could deny or remain agnostic towards the claims of science, and still attempt to justify our mathematical beliefs using Putnam’s indispensability argument.

The first two premises of PS are uncontroversial, so Putnam’s defense of PS focuses on its third premise. His argument for that premise is essentially a rejection of the argument that mathematics could be indispensable, yet not true. “It is silly to agree that a reason for believing that p warrants accepting p in all scientific circumstances, and then to add ‘but even so it is not good enough’” (Putnam 1971: 356).

For the Quinean holist, Putnam’s argument for PS3 has some force. Such a holist has no external perspective from which to evaluate the mathematics in scientific theory as merely useful. The holist can not say, “Well, I commit to mathematical objects within scientific theory, but I don’t really mean that they exist.”

In contrast, the opponent of PS may abandon the claim that our most sincere commitments are found in the quantifications of our single best theory. Instead, such an opponent might claim that only objects which have causal relations to ordinary physical objects exist. Such a critic is free to deny that mathematical objects exist, despite their utility in science, and nothing in PS prevents such a move, in the way that QI1-QI3 do for Quine’s original argument.

More importantly, any account of the applicability of mathematics to the natural world other than the indispensabilist’s refutes PS3. For example, Mark Balaguer’s plenitudinous platonism claims that mathematics provides a theoretical apparatus which applies to all possible states of the world. (See Balaguer 1998.) It explains the applicability of mathematics to the natural world, non-miraculously, since any possible state of the natural world will be described by some mathematical theory.

Similarly, and more influentially, Hartry Field has argued that the reason that mathematics is successful as the language of science is because it is conservative over nominalist versions of scientific theories. (See Field 1980, especially the preliminary remarks and Chapter 1.) In other words, Field claims that mathematics is just a convenient shorthand for a theory which includes no mathematical axioms.

In response, one could amend PS3 to improve Putnam’s argument:

PS3*: Realism best explains the success of mathematics as the language of science.

A defense of the new argument, PS*, would entail showing that realism is a better explanation of the utility of mathematics than other options.

4. Resnik’s Pragmatic Indispensability Argument

Michael Resnik, like Putnam, presents both a holistic indispensability argument, such as Quine’s, and a non-holistic argument called the pragmatic indispensability argument. In the pragmatic argument, Resnik first links mathematical and scientific justification.

RP: RP1. In stating its laws and conducting its derivations, science assumes the existence of many mathematical objects and the truth of much mathematics.
RP2. These assumptions are indispensable to the pursuit of science; moreover, many of the important conclusions drawn from and within science could not be drawn without taking mathematical claims to be true.
RP3. So, we are justified in drawing conclusions from and within science only if we are justified in taking the mathematics used in science to be true.
RP4. We are justified in using science to explain and predict.
RP5. The only way we know of using science thus involves drawing conclusions from and within it.
RPC. So, by RP3, we are justified in taking mathematics to be true (Resnik 1997: 46-8).

RP, like PS, avoids the problems that may undermine our confidence in science. Even if our best scientific theories are false, their undeniable practical utility still justifies our using them. RP states that we need to presume the truth of mathematics even if science is merely useful. The key premises for RP, then, are the first two. If we can also take mathematics to be merely useful, then those premises are unjustified. The question for the proponent of RP, then, is how to determine whether science really presumes the existence of mathematical objects, and mathematical truth. How do we determine the commitments of scientific theory?

We could ask scientists about their beliefs, but they may work without considering the question of mathematical truth at all. Like PS, RP seems liable to the critic who claims that the same laws and derivations in science can be stated while taking mathematics to be merely useful. (See Azzouni 2004, Leng 2005, and Melia 2000.) The defender of RP needs a procedure for determining the commitments of science that blocks such a response, if not a more general procedure for determining our commitments. RP may thus be best interpreted as a reference back to Quine’s holistic argument, which provided both.

5. The Explanatory Indispensability Argument

Alan Baker and Mark Colyvan have defended an explanatory indispensability argument (Mancosu 2008: section 3.2; see also Baker 2005 and Lyon and Colyvan 2008).

EI: EI1. There are genuinely mathematical explanations of empirical phenomena.
EI2. We ought to be committed to the theoretical posits in such explanations.
EIC. We ought to be committed to the entities postulated by the mathematics in question.

EI differs from Quine’s original indispensability argument QI, and other versions of the argument, by seeking the justification for our mathematical beliefs in scientific explanations which rely on mathematics, rather than in scientific theories. Mathematical explanation and scientific explanation are difficult and controversial topics, beyond the scope of this article. Still, two comments are appropriate.

First, it is unclear whether EI is intended as a greater demand on the indispensabilist than the standard indispensability argument. Does the platonist have to show that mathematical objects are indispensable in both our best theories and our best explanations, or just in one of them? Conversely, must the nominalist dispense with mathematics in both theories and explanations?

Second, EI, like Putnam’s success argument and Resnik’s pragmatic argument, leaves open the question of how one is supposed to determine the commitments of an explanation. EI2 refers to the theoretical posits postulated by explanations, but does not tell us how we are supposed to figure out what an explanation posits. If the commitments of a scientific explanation are found in the best scientific theory used in that explanation, then EI is no improvement on QI. If, on the other hand, EI is supposed to be a new and independent argument, its proponents must present a new and independent criterion for determining the commitments of explanations.

Given the development of the explanatory indispensability argument and the current interest in mathematical explanation, it is likely that more work will be done on these questions.

6. Characteristics of Indispensability Arguments in the Philosophy of Mathematics

Quine’s indispensability argument relies on specific claims about how we determine our commitments, and on what our canonical language must be. Putnam’s success argument, Resnik’s pragmatic argument, and the explanatory indispensability argument are more general, since they do not specify a particular method for determining the commitments of a theory. Putnam and Resnik maintain that we are committed to mathematics because of the ineliminable role that mathematical objects play in scientific theory. Proponents of the explanatory argument argue that our mathematical beliefs are justified by the role that mathematics plays in scientific explanations.

Indispensability arguments in the philosophy of mathematics can be quite general, and can rely on supposedly indispensable uses of mathematics in a wide variety of contexts. For instance, in later work, Putnam defends belief in mathematical objects for their indispensability in explaining our mathematical intuitions. (See Putnam 1994: 506.) Since he thinks that our mathematical intuitions derive exclusively from our sense experience, this later argument may still be classified as an indispensability argument.

Here are some characteristics of many indispensability arguments in the philosophy of mathematics, no matter how general:

Naturalism: The job of the philosopher, as of the scientist, is exclusively to understand our sensible experience of the physical world.
Theory Construction: In order to explain our sensible experience we construct a theory, or theories, of the physical world. We find our commitments exclusively in our best theory or theories.
Mathematization: Some mathematical objects are ineliminable from our best theory or theories.
Subordination of Practice: Mathematical practice depends for its legitimacy on natural scientific practice.

Although the indispensability argument is a late twentieth century development, earlier philosophers may have held versions of the argument. Mark Colyvan classifies arguments from both Frege and Gödel as indispensability arguments, on the strength of their commitments to Theory Construction and Mathematization. (See Colyvan 2001: 8-9.) Both Frege and Gödel, though, deny Naturalism and Subordination of Practice, so they are not indispensabilists according to the characterization in this section.

7. Responses to the Indispensability Argument

The most influential approach to denying the indispensability argument is to reject the claim that mathematics is essential to science. The main strategy for this response is to introduce scientific or mathematical theories which entail all of the consequences of standard theories, but which do not refer to mathematical objects. Such nominalizing strategies break into two groups.

In the first group are theories which show how to eliminate quantification over mathematical objects within scientific theories. Hartry Field has shown how we can reformulate some physical theories to quantify over space-time regions rather than over sets. (See Field 1980 and Field 1989.) According to Field, mathematics is useful because it is a convenient shorthand for more complicated statements about physical quantities. John Burgess has extended Field’s work. (See Burgess 1984, Burgess 1991a, and Burgess and Rosen 1997.) Mark Balaguer has presented steps toward nominalizing quantum mechanics. (See Balaguer 1998.)

The second group of nominalizing strategies attempts to reformulate mathematical theories to avoid commitments to mathematical objects. Charles Chihara (Chihara 1990), Geoffrey Hellman (Hellman 1989), and Hilary Putnam (Putnam 1967b and Putnam 1975a) have all explored modal reformulations of mathematical theories. Modal reformulations replace claims about mathematical objects with claims about possibility.

Another line of criticism of the indispensability argument is that the argument is insufficient to generate a satisfying mathematical ontology. For example, no scientific theory requires any more than א1 sets; we don’t need anything nearly as powerful as the full ZFC hierarchy. But, standard set theory entails the existence of much larger cardinalities. Quine calls such un-applied mathematics “mathematical recreation” (Quine 1986b: 400).

The indispensabilist can justify extending mathematical ontology a little bit beyond those objects explicitly required for science, for simplicity and rounding out. But few indispensabilists have shown interest in justifying beliefs in, say, inaccessible cardinals. (Though, see Colyvan 2007 for such an attempt.) Thus, the indispensabilist has a restricted ontology. Similarly, the indispensability argument may be criticized for making mathematical epistemology a posteriori, rather than  a priori, and for classifying mathematical truths as contingent, rather than necessary. Indispensabilists may welcome these departures from traditional interpretations of mathematics. (For example, see Colyvan 2001, Chapter 6.)

8. Inter-theoretic and Intra-theoretic Indispensability Arguments

Indispensability arguments need not be restricted to the philosophy of mathematics. Considered more generally, an indispensability argument is an inference to the best explanation which transfers evidence for one set of claims to another. If the transfer crosses disciplinary lines, we can call the argument an inter-theoretic indispensability argument. If evidence is transferred within a theory, we can call the argument an intra-theoretic indispensability argument. The indispensability argument in the philosophy of mathematics transfers evidence from natural science to mathematics. Thus, this argument is an inter-theoretic indispensability argument.

One might apply inter-theoretic indispensability arguments in other areas. For example, one could argue that we should believe in gravitational fields (physics) because they are ineliminable from our explanations of why zebras do not go flying off into space (biology). We might think that biological laws reduce, in some sense, to physical laws, or we might think that they are independent of physics, or supervenient on physics. Still, our beliefs in some basic claims of physics seem indispensable to other sciences.

As an example of an intra-theoretic indispensability argument, consider the justification for our believing in the existence of atoms. Atomic theory makes accurate predictions which extend to the observable world. It has led to a deeper understanding of the world, as well as further successful research. Despite our lacking direct perception of atoms, they play an indispensable role in atomic theory. According to atomic theory, atoms exist. Thus, according to an intra-theoretic indispensability argument, we should believe that atoms exist.

As an example of an intra-theoretic indispensability argument within mathematics, consider Church’s Thesis. Church’s Thesis claims that our intuitive notion of an algorithm is equivalent to the technical notion of a recursive function. Church’s Thesis is not provable, in the ordinary sense. But, it might be defended by using an intra-theoretic indispensability argument: Church’s Thesis is fruitful, and, arguably, indispensable to our understanding of mathematics.  For another example, Quine’s argument for QI2, that we must believe in the commitments of any theory we accept, might itself also be called an intra-theoretic indispensability argument.

9. Conclusion

There are at least three ways of arguing for empirical justification of mathematics. The first is to argue, as John Stuart Mill did, that mathematical beliefs are about ordinary, physical objects to which we have sensory access. The second is to argue that, although mathematical beliefs are about abstract mathematical objects, we have sensory access to such objects. (See Maddy 1990.) The currently most popular way to justify mathematics empirically is to argue:

A. Mathematical beliefs are about abstract objects;

B. We have experiences only with physical objects; and yet

C. Our experiences with physical objects justify our mathematical beliefs.

This is the indispensability argument in the philosophy of mathematics.

10. References and Further Reading

  • Azzouni, Jody.  2004. Deflating Existential Consequence: A Case for Nominalism. Oxford University Press.
  • Azzouni, Jody.  1998. “On ‘On What There Is’.”  Pacific Philosophical Quarterly 79: 1-18.
  • Azzouni, Jody.  1997b. “Applied Mathematics, Existential Commitment, and the Quine-Putnam Indispensability Thesis.”  Philosophia Mathematica (3) 5: 193-209.
  • Baker, Alan.  2005. “Are there Genuine Mathematical Explanations of Physical Phenomena?” Mind: 114: 223-238.
  • Baker, Alan.  2003. “The Indispensability Argument and Multiple Foundations for Mathematics.” The Philosophical Quarterly 53.210: 49-67.
  • Baker, Alan.  2001. “Mathematics, Indispensability and Scientific Practice.” Erkenntnis 55: 85 116.
  • Balaguer, Mark.  1998. Platonism and Anti-Platonism in Mathematics. New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Balaguer, Mark.  1996. “Toward a Nominalization of Quantum Mechanics.”  Mind 105: 209-226.
  • Bangu, Sorin Ioan.  2008. “Inference to the Best Explanation and Mathematical Realism.” Synthese 160: 13-20.
  • Benacerraf, Paul.  1973.  “Mathematical Truth.”   In Paul Benacerraf and Hilary Putnam, eds., Philosophy of Mathematics: Selected Readings, second edition, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1983.
  • Burgess, John.  1991b. “Synthetic Physics and Nominalist Realism.”  In C. Wade Savage and Philip Ehrlich, Philosophical and Foundational Issues in Measurement Theory, Hillsdale: Lawrence Erlblum Associates, 1992.
  • Burgess, John.  1991a. “Synthetic Mechanics Revisited.” Journal of Philosophical Logic 20: 121-130. Burgess, John.  1984. “Synthetic Mechanics.” Journal of Philosophical Logic 13: 379-395.
  • Burgess, John.  1983. “Why I am Not a Nominalist.”  Notre Dame Journal of Formal Logic 24.1: 93-105. Burgess, John, and Gideon Rosen.  1997. A Subject with No Object. New York: Oxford.
  • Cartwright, Nancy.  1983. How the Laws of Physics Lie. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Chihara, Charles.  1990. Constructabiliy and Mathematical Existence. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Colyvan, Mark.  2007.  “Mathematical Recreation versus Mathematical Knowledge.”  In Leng, Mary, Alexander Paseau and Michael Potter, eds, Mathematical Knowledge, Oxford University Press, 109-122.
  • Colyvan, Mark.  2002. “Mathematics and Aesthetic Considerations in Science.”  Mind 11: 69-78.
  • Colyvan, Mark.  2001. The Indispensability of Mathematics. Oxford University Press.
  • Field, Hartry.  1989. Realism, Mathematics, and Modality. Oxford: Basil Blackwell.
  • Field, Hartry.  1980. Science Without Numbers. Princeton: Princeton University Press.
  • Frege, Gottlob.  1953. The Foundations of Arithmetic. Evanston: Northwestern University Press.
  • Gödel, Kurt.  1963. “What is Cantor’s Continuum Problem?” In Paul Benacerraf and Hilary Putnam, eds., Philosophy of Mathematics: Selected Readings, second edition. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1983.
  • Gödel, Kurt.  1961. “The Modern Development of the Foundations of Mathematics in the Light of Philosophy.”  In Solomon Feferman et al., eds., Kurt Gödel: Collected Works, Vol. III. New York: Oxford University Press, 1995.
  • Hellman, Geoffrey.  1989. Mathematics Without Numbers. New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Hintikka, Jaakko.  1973. “Quantifiers vs Quantification Theory.”  Dialectica 27.3: 329-358.
  • Leng, Mary.  2005.  “Mathematical Explanation.”  In Cellucci, Carlo and Donald Gillies eds, Mathematical Reasoning and Heuristics, King’s College Publications, London, 167-189.
  • Lyon, Aidan and Mark Colyvan.  2007. “The Explanatory Power of Phase Spaces.” Philosophia Mathematica 16.2: 227-243.
  • Maddy, Penelope.  1992. “Indispensability and Practice.”  The Journal of Philosophy 89: 275­-289.
  • Maddy, Penelope. 1990. Realism in Mathematics. Oxford: Clarendon Press. Mancosu, Paolo.  “Explanation in Mathematics.”  The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Fall 2008 Edition), Edward N. Zalta (ed.).
  • Marcus, Russell.  2007. “Structuralism, Indispensability, and the Access Problem.” Facta Philosophica 9, 2007: 203-211.
  • Melia, Joseph.  2002. “Response to Colyvan.”  Mind 111: 75-79.
  • Melia, Joseph.  2000. “Weaseling Away the Indispensability Argument.”  Mind 109: 455-479.
  • Melia, Joseph.  1998. “Field’s Programme: Some Interference.”  Analysis 58.2: 63-71.
  • Mendelson, Elliott.  1997. Introduction to Mathematical Logic, 4th ed.  Chapman & Hall/CRC.
  • Mill, John Stuart.  1941. A System of Logic, Ratiocinative and Inductive: Being a Connected View of the Principles of Evidence and the Methods of Scientific Investigation. London, Longmans, Green.
  • Putnam, Hilary.  1994.  “Philosophy of Mathematics: Why Nothing Works.” In his Words and Life. Cambridge: Harvard University Press.
  • Putnam, Hilary.  1975b. Mathematics, Matter, and Method: Philosophical Papers, Vol. I. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Putnam, Hilary. 1975a. “What is Mathematical Truth?”  In Putnam 1975b. Putnam, Hilary.  1974. “Science as Approximation to Truth.”  In Putnam 1975b.
  • Putnam, Hilary.  1971. Philosophy of Logic. In Putnam 1975b.
  • Putnam, Hilary.  1967b. “Mathematics Without Foundations.”  In Putnam 1975b.
  • Putnam, Hilary.  1967a. “The Thesis that Mathematics is Logic.”  In Putnam 1975b.
  • Putnam, Hilary.  1956. “Mathematics and the Existence of Abstract Entities.”  Philosophical Studies 7: 81-88.
  • Quine, W.V. 1995. From Stimulus to Science. Cambridge: Harvard University Press.
  • Quine, W.V. 1986b. “Reply to Charles Parsons.” In Lewis Edwin Hahn and Paul Arthur Schilpp, eds., The Philosophy of W.V. Quine. La Salle: Open Court, 1986.
  • Quine, W.V. 1986a. Philosophy of Logic, 2nd edition.  Cambridge: Harvard University Press.
  • Quine, W.V. 1981. Theories and Things. Cambridge: Harvard University Press.
  • Quine, W.V.  1980. From a Logical Point of View. Cambridge: Harvard University Press.
  • Quine, W.V.  1978. “Success and the Limits of Mathematization.”  In Quine 1981.
  • Quine, W.V.  1969. Ontological Relativity and Other Essays. New York: Columbia University Press. Quine, W.V.  1960. Word & Object. Cambridge: The MIT Press.
  • Quine, W.V.  1958. “Speaking of Objects.”  In Quine 1969.
  • Quine, W.V.  1955. “Posits and Reality.”  In The Ways of Paradox. Cambridge: Harvard University Press, 1976.
  • Quine, W.V.  1951. “Two Dogmas of Empiricism.”  In Quine 1980.
  • Quine, W.V.  1948. “On What There Is.”  In Quine 1980.
  • Quine, W.V.  1939. “Designation and Existence.”  In Feigl and Sellars, Readings in Philosophical Analysis, Appleton-Century-Crofts, Inc., New York: 1940.
  • Resnik, Michael.  1997. Mathematics as a Science of Patterns. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Resnik, Michael.  1995. “Scientific vs. Mathematical Realism: The Indispensability Argument.  Philosophia Mathematica (3) 3: 166-174.
  • Resnik, Michael D.  1993. “A Naturalized Epistemology for a Platonist Mathematical Ontology.”  In Sal Restivo, et. al., eds., Math Worlds: Philosophical and Social Studies of Mathematics and Mathematics Education, Albany: SUNY Press, 1993.
  • Shapiro, Stewart.  Foundations without Foundationalism: A Case for Second-Order Logic. Oxford University Press, 1991.
  • Sher, Gila. 1990. “Ways of Branching Quantifiers.” Linguistics and Philosophy 13: 393-422.
  • Sober, Elliott.  1993. “Mathematics and Indispensability.”  The Philosophical Review 102: 35-57.
  • Tarski, Alfred.  1944. “The Semantic Conception of Truth: and the Foundations of Semantics.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 4.3: 341-376.
  • Van Fraassen, Bas C.  1980. The Scientific Image. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Whitehead, Alfred North and Bertrand Russell.  1997. Principia Mathematica to *56. Cambridge University Press.

Author Information

Russell Marcus
Email: rmarcus1@hamilton.edu
Hamilton College
U. S. A.

Transmission and Transmission Failure in Epistemology

An argument transmits justification to its conclusion just in case, roughly, the conclusion is justified in virtue of the premises’ being justified.  An argument fails to transmit justification just in case, roughly, the conclusion is not justified in virtue of the premises’ being justified.  An argument might fail to transmit justification for a variety of uncontroversial reasons, such as the premise’s being unjustified; the premises’ failing to support the conclusion; or the argument’s exhibiting premise circularity.  There are transmission issues concerning testimony, but this article focuses on when arguments (fail to) transmit justification or knowledge or some other epistemic status.

Transmission failure is an interesting issue because it is difficult to identify what, if anything, prevents competent deductions from justifying their conclusions.  One makes a competent deduction when she accepts a deductive argument in certain circumstances.  These deductions seem to be the paradigmatic form of reasoning in that they apparently must transmit justification to their conclusions.  At the same time, though, certain competent deductions seem bad.  Consider Moore’s Proof:  I have a hand therefore there is at least one material thing.  Some philosophers hold that Moore’s Proof cannot transmit justification to its conclusion under any circumstances, and so, despite appearances, some competent deductions are instances of transmission failure.  Identifying what, if anything, prevents such arguments from justifying their conclusions is a tricky, controversial affair.

Transmission principles are intimately connected with closure principles.  An epistemic closure principle might say that, if one knows P and deduces Q from P, then one knows that Q.  Closure principles are silent as to what makes Q known, but the corresponding transmission principles are not.  A transmission principle might say that, if one knows P and deduces Q from P, then one knows Q in virtue of knowing P.

Those sympathetic to Moore’s Proof sometimes say that the “proof” can justify its conclusion even though it lacks the power to resolve doubt.  An argument can resolve doubt about its conclusion when the argument can justify its conclusion even for a subject who antecedently disbelieves or withholds judgment about the argument’s conclusion.

Table of Contents

  1. Transmission: The General Concept
  2. Transmission in Epistemology
  3. Transmission Failure
    1. Uncontroversial Causes
    2. Why Transmission Failure is an Interesting Issue
    3. Two More Puzzling Cases
  4. Transmission (Failure) vs. Closure (Failure)
    1. The Basic Difference
    2. The (Misplaced?) Focus on Closure
    3. Why Transmission is an Interesting Issue, Revisited
  5. Transmission Failure: Two Common Assumptions
    1. Transmission of Warrant vs. Transmission of Justification
    2. Transmission vs. Resolving Doubt
  6. References and Further Reading

1. Transmission: The General Concept

The term ‘transmission’ is not unique to philosophical discourse: religious and cultural traditions often are transmitted from one generation to the next; diseases from one person to another; and information of various kinds from one computer to another (often via the internet).  A car’s transmission gets its name from its intended purpose, namely to transmit the energy from the engine to its wheels (to put it crudely).  The use of ‘transmission’ in epistemological contexts is deeply connected to its use in everyday contexts.  Tucker (2010, section 1) holds that one can clarify the epistemological concept of transmission by considering an everyday instance of transmission.

Under what conditions does Alvin’s computer A transmit information to another computer B?  Tucker suggests it will do so just in case (i) A had the information and (ii) B has the information in virtue of A’s having it.  The first condition is very intuitive.  If A does not have the information but B acquires it anyway, it may be true that something transmitted the information to B.  Yet, unless A has the information, it won’t be true that A transmitted the information to B.  The second condition is intuitive but vague.  If B has the information in virtue of A’s having it, then A causes B to have it.  Yet mere causation is not enough to satisfy this in virtue of relation.  If A sends the information to B over an Ethernet or USB cable, we do seem to have the requisite sort of causal relation, and, in these cases, A seems to transmit the information to B.

Suppose A just finished downloading the information, which makes Alvin so excited that he does a wild victory dance.  During this dance he accidently hits B’s keyboard, which causes B to download the information from the internet (and not Alvin’s computer).  In such a case, A’s having the information causes B to have it, but the information was not transmitted from A to B.  Although transmission requires that a causal relation hold, not just any causal relation will do.  This article will follow Tucker in using ‘in virtue of’ as a placeholder for whatever causal relation is required for transmission.

Generalizing from this example, Tucker concludes that transmission is a three-place relation between: (i) the property P that is transmitted; (ii) the thing a from which the property is transmitted; and (iii) the thing b to which the property is transmitted.  A property P is transmitted from a to b just in case b has P in virtue of a’s having P.  In the above example, the property P is having the information; a is A, Alvin’s computer; and b is B, some other computer.  So A transmits the information to B just in case B has the information in virtue of A’s having it.

The preceding discussion clarifies statements of the form ‘a transmits P to b’, but there is another, more informative kind of transmission ascription, which we can symbolize as ‘R transmits P from a to b’.  Contrast ‘A transmitted the information to B’ with the equally natural expression ‘The USB cable transmitted the information from A to B’.  Whereas the former notes only that the information was transmitted from A to B, the latter additionally notes how it was transmitted.  Under what conditions does the USB cable (more precisely: being connected by the USB cable) transmit the information from A to B?  I suggest that it will do so just in case (i) A had the information and (ii) B has the information in virtue of both A’s having it and A’s being connected by a USB cable to B.

2. Transmission in Epistemology

When epistemologists consider transmission or transmission failure, they generally ask such questions as:

  • Under what conditions does entailment transmit justification?
  • Under what conditions do competent deductions transmit rational belief?
  • Does testimony transmit knowledge?

Epistemologists, then, are concerned with whether some relation (for example, entailment, competent deduction, testimony) transmits some epistemic property (for example, being rational, being justified, being known, or being defeated).  They tend to have in mind, therefore, the more informative sort of transmission ascription (see section 1).  That is, they are concerned not just with whether a belief is, say, known in virtue of another belief’s being known; they are also concerned with whether, say, entailment is the particular relation that allows the first belief to be known in virtue of the second.

This article will focus exclusively on when arguments or inferences (fail to) transmit some epistemic value property, such as being justified or being known.  The reason is that, when philosophers talk about transmission failure as an independent issue, they tend to have in mind the conditions under which an argument or inference fails to transmit.  The conditions under which testimony (fails to) transmit, say, knowledge is an interesting and important issue.  Yet these issues are often pursued in conjunction with or subsumed under other important issues relating to testimony, such as the conditions under which testimony preserves knowledge.  (For a brief intro to some of the relevant transmission issues pertaining to testimony, see Lackey 2008, section 3.)  In any case, this article will focus on the transmission issues pertaining to arguments or inferences, rather than the issues pertaining to testimony or other epistemically interesting relations.

An argument is a set of propositions such that one proposition, the conclusion, is supported by or is taken to be supported by the other propositions in that set, the premises.  An argument, as such, is merely a set of propositions that bear a special relation with one another.  Arguments can play a role in transmitting justification or knowledge when a subject believes the premises or when a subject infers the conclusion from the premises.  If epistemic transmission is analogous to the above computer transmission case (sec. 1), then an argument transmits justification to its conclusion when (i) the premises have some epistemically valuable status (for example, being justified, being known) and (ii) the conclusion has that same status in virtue of the premises’ having it.  (Here and elsewhere, for the sake of simplicity, I ignore the additional complexity of the more informative transmission ascriptions.)  The following case seems to satisfy (i) and (ii), and so it seems to transmit justification from the premises to the conclusion.

The Counting Case: Consider this argument: (a) that there are exactly 25 people in the room; and (b) that if there are exactly 25 people in the room, then there are fewer than 100 people in the room; therefore (c) there are fewer than 100 people in the room.  Suppose that Counter justifiably believes (a) on the basis of perception; that he justifiably believes (b) a priori; and that he believes (c) on the basis of (a) and (b).

The counting case seems to be a paradigmatic case of successful transmission.  Counter’s belief in the premises, namely (a) and (b), are justified (so (i) is satisfied), and the conclusion, namely (c), seems to be justified in virtue the premises’ being justified (so (ii) is satisfied).  Notice, however, that whether an argument transmits is relative to a subject.  The argument in the Counting Case transmits for Counter but not for someone who lacks justification for the premises.

The Counting Case also illustrates the deep connection between the transmission of justification and inferential justification.  When philosophers address inferential justification, they are concerned with the conditions under which the premises of an argument justify the argument’s conclusion. If one belief (belief in the premise) justifies another belief (belief in the conclusion), belief in the conclusion is inferentially justified.  Notice that the conclusion in the counting case is inferentially justified because it is justified by its premises.  The Counting Case, therefore, illustrates both inferential justification and the successful transmission of justification.  This is no accident.  It is almost universally assumed that inferential justification works by transmission; it is assumed that when the conclusion is justified by the premises, the premises transmit their justification to their conclusions.  Hence, the transmission of justification across an argument is deeply connected to inferential justification.

It should be noted that sometimes, when philosophers talk about transmission, they use the term “transfer” rather than “transmission” (for example, Davies 1998).  The latter terminology seems preferable, as Davies now admits (2000: 393, nt. 17).  “Transfer” often connotes that, when P is transferred from a to b, a no longer has P.  If I transfer water from one cup to another, the transferred water is no longer in the first cup.  “Transmission” lacks that connotation: when a computer transmits some information to another computer, the first computer typically retains the transmitted information.

3. Transmission Failure

a. Uncontroversial Causes

An argument is an instance of transmission failure just in case it does not transmit (some degree of) justification (or whatever epistemic status is at issue) from the premises to the conclusion.  Arguments can fail to transmit justification to their conclusions for a number of reasons.  Here are a few relatively uncontroversial causes of transmission failure:

  • Unjustified Premises: If an argument’s premises are all unjustified, then the argument is a trivial case of transmission failure; for the premises had no justification to transmit to its conclusion in the first place.  It does not follow, though, that all of an inference’s premises must be justified for it to transmit justification to its conclusion.  Consider an inductive inference with 100 premises of the form ‘on this occasion the unsuspended pencil fell to the ground’.  If 99 of the 100 premises are justified, it seems that those 100 premises can transmit justification to the belief that the next unsuspended pencil will also fall, despite that one of the premises fails to be justified.  (See the article “Deductive and Inductive Arguments” for a brief explanation of the differences between deductive and inductive arguments.)
  • Premise Circularity:  An argument is premise circular just in case its ultimate conclusion also appears as a premise.  For instance, consider P therefore Q therefore P.  The ultimate conclusion, P, is used as the sole premise for the intermediate conclusion, Q.  Even given that P transmits justification to Q, it seems clear that the justification P has in virtue of Q cannot be transmitted back to Q.  (The term ‘premise circular’ will be used loosely, such that both the extended argument P therefore Q therefore P and the second stage of the argument, Q therefore P, are premise circular.)
  • The Premises Fail to Evidentially Support Their Conclusion: Consider the argument: ‘I have a hand; therefore, the Stay Puft Marshmallow Man is eating a Ghostbuster’.  The premise is justified; however, it fails to transmit its justification to the conclusion because having a hand is not evidence that the Marshmallow Man is doing anything, much less eating a Ghostbuster.
  • The Premises Provide Less Than Maximal Evidential Support: An argument that provides maximal evidential support, such as one in the form of modus ponens, is capable of transmitting all of its premises’ justification to the conclusion.  Arguments that provide some less-than-maximal degree of support, such as a good inductive argument, fail to transmit all of the premises’ justification to the conclusion.  Good inductive arguments with justified premises both partially transmit and partially fail to transmit justification from the premises to the conclusion.  Other things being equal, the stronger the support, the more justification the argument transmits from the premises to the conclusion.
  • Defeaters: A good argument might fail to transmit justification because one has a relevant defeater (for example, relevant counterevidence).  Suppose I believe some mathematical theorem T on what is in fact exemplary deductive reasoning.  If I know that my coffee has been spiked with a drug known to cause egregious errors in reasoning, then my exemplary deductive reasoning is an instance of at least partial transmission failure.

b. Why Transmission Failure is an Interesting Issue

It is relatively uninteresting if an argument fails to transmit for any of the above reasons.  But suppose an argument has well-justified premises; the premises provide deductive (so maximal) support for their conclusion; the subject knows that the premises provide deductive support for their conclusions; there are no relevant defeaters; and it is not premise circular.  A person makes a competent deduction when they accept such an argument.  (Others use the term “competent deduction,” but they often mean something slightly different by the term, including Tucker (2010).)  One might think that competent deductions are the paradigm of good reasoning, that they must transmit justification to their conclusions.  Interest in transmission failure arises because, at first glance at least, there are such arguments that do seem to be instances of transmission failure.  Interest in transmission failure persists because it is very hard to identify what would cause such arguments to be instances of transmission failure.  Consider the following example.

Some philosophers, sometimes called “idealists,” hold that the only things that exist are minds and their ideas.  These idealists, therefore, are skeptics about material objects.  In other words, they reject that there are material objects, where material objects are non-mental objects composed of matter.  These philosophers tend to hold that there are ideas of hands but no hands.  There are ideas of chairs, even apparent perceptions of chairs, but there are no chairs.  Responding to these idealists, G. E. Moore declared that he could prove the existence of the external, or non-mental, world.  Here is his “proof”:

Moore’s Proof (MP)

(MP1)   I have a hand.

(If I have a hand, then there is at least one material object.)

(MP2)  There is at least one material object.

This argument is widely criticized and scorned.  Yet if it fails to transmit justification to its conclusion, why does it do so?

Well, Moore’s Proof is not an instance of transmission failure for any of the obvious reasons: it is a deductive argument; its premise seems well-justified on the basis of perceptual experience; there are no relevant defeaters; and it is not premise circular (that is, Moore did not—or at least need not—use MP2, the conclusion of Moore’s Proof, as a premise for his belief in MP1).  Still, it is hard to dispel the sense that this argument is bad.  This argument seems to beg the question against the skeptic, but it is unclear whether question-begging, by itself, can cause transmission failure (see sec. 5b).  Perhaps Moore’s Proof is not just question-begging, but also viciously circular in some way.  The problem is that it is hard to identify a type of circularity that both afflicts Moore’s argument and is clearly bad.

c. Two More Puzzling Cases

Moore’s Proof is a puzzling case.  If one accepts Moore’s Proof, she has made a competent deduction, which would seem to make it the paradigm of good reasoning.  Nonetheless, it still seems to be a bad argument.  The puzzling nature of this case also appears in a variety of other arguments, including the following two arguments.

Moore’s Proof is aimed at disproving idealism insofar as it is committed to skepticism about the material world, that is, the claim that the external world does not exist.  Consider, however, perceptual skepticism, the idea that, even if the external world does exist, our perceptual experiences do not give us knowledge (directly or via an inference) of this non-mental realm. Proponents of this skepticism typically concoct scenarios in which we would have exactly the same experiences that we do have, but where our perceptual experiences are wildly unreliable.  One popular scenario is that I am the unwitting victim of a mad scientist.  The mad scientist removed my brain, placed it in a vat of nutrients, and then hooked me up to his supercomputer.  In addition to keeping me alive, this supercomputer provides me with a computer generated reality, much like the virtual reality described by the movie Matrix.  Although all of my perceptual experiences are wildly unreliable, they seem just as genuine and trustworthy as my actual experiences.  The skeptic then reasons as follows: if you cannot tell whether you are merely a brain-in-a-vat in the above scenario, then you do not know you have a hand; you cannot tell whether you are a brain-in-a-vat (because your experiences would seem just as genuine even if you were a brain-in-a-vat); therefore, you do not know whether you have a hand.  (See Contemporary Skepticism, especially section 1, for further discussion of this type of skepticism.)

Some philosophers respond that the sort of reasoning in Moore’s Proof can be applied to rule out the skeptical hypothesis that we are brains-in-vats.  Hence:

The Neo-Moorean Argument

(NM1)    I have a hand.

(If I have a hand, then I am not a brain-in-a-vat.)

(NM2)    I am not a brain-in-a-vat.

The Neo-Moorean Argument is just as puzzling as Moore’s Proof.  If one accepts the Neo-Moorean Argument, she has accepted a competent deduction which seems to be the paradigm of good reasoning.  Yet the argument still seems bad, which is why some philosophers hold that it is an instance of transmission failure.

The Zebra Argument, like the Neo-Moorean Argument, is intended to rule out a certain kind of skeptical scenario.  Bobby is at the zoo and sees what appears to be zebra.  Quite naturally, he believes that the creature is a zebra on the basis of its looking like one.  His son, however, is not convinced and asks: “Dad, if a mule is disguised cleverly enough, it will look just like a real zebra.  So how do you know that the creature isn’t a cleverly disguised mule?”  Bobby answers his son’s question with:

The Zebra Argument

(Z1)        That creature is a zebra.

(If it is a zebra, then it is not a cleverly disguised mule.)

(Z2)        It is not a cleverly disguised mule.

It seems that to know that the creature is a zebra, one must know already in some sense that the creature is not a cleverly disguised mule.  Hence, Bobby’s argument seems to exhibit a suspicious type of circularity despite qualifying as a competent deduction.

(There is a rather wide variety of other puzzling cases.  For reasons that will be explained in the next section, arguments that allegedly violate closure principles are also potential examples of transmission failure.  Readers interested in semantic or content externalism should consider McKinsey’s Paradox in section 5 of the closure principles article.  Readers with expertise in the philosophy of mind might be interested in some examples raised by Davies (2003: secs. 3, 5).)

4. Transmission (Failure) vs. Closure (Failure)

Discussions of transmission and transmission failure are connected intimately with discussions of closure and closure failure, which raises the question of how these issues are related.

a. The Basic Difference

Closure principles say, roughly, that if one thing a has some property P and bears some relation R to another thing b, then b also will have P.  More succinctly (and ignoring universal quantification for simplicity’s sake), closure principles say that, if Pa and Rab, then Pb.  Suppose that the property being a pig is closed under the relation being the same species as.  Suppose, in other words, that if Albert is a pig, then anything that is the same species as Albert is also a pig.  Given this assumption, if Albert is a pig and Brutus is the same species as Albert, then Brutus is a pig.  Yet being a pig is clearly not closed under the relation being the same genus as.  Pigs are in the genus mammal along with humans, cows, poodles, and many other creatures.  If Albert is a pig and Brutus is in the same genus as Albert, it does not follow that Brutus is a pig.  Brutus could be a terribly ferocious poodle and still be in the same genus as Albert.

In epistemological contexts, the relevant P will be an epistemic property, such as being justified or known, and R will be something like being competently deduced from or being known to entail.  An epistemic closure principle might say: If Billy knows P and Billy competently deduces Q from P, then Billy also knows Q.

Transmission principles are stronger than their closure counterparts.  Transmission principles, in other words, say everything that their closure counterparts say and more besides.  Recall that closure principles hold that, if Pa and Rab, then Pb.   Transmission principles hold instead that, if Pa and Rab, then Pb in virtue of Pa. Closure principles merely say that b has the property P, but they do not specify why b has that property.  Transmission principles say not only that b has P, but also that b has P because, or in virtue of, Pa and Rab.

Notice that a closure principle can be true when the corresponding transmission principle is false.  Consider:

Pig Closure: If Albert is a pig and is the same species as Brutus, then Brutus is also a pig.

Pig Transmission: If Albert is a pig and is the same species as Brutus, then Brutus is a pig in virtue of Albert’s being a pig.

Even though we are assuming that Pig Closure is true, Pig Transmission will be false when Albert and Brutus are unrelated pigs.  Brutus’ being a pig might be explained by his parents being pigs and/or his having a certain DNA structure, but not by Albert’s being a pig.  Although closure principles can be true when their transmission counterparts are false, if a transmission principle is true, its closure counterpart must also be true.  This is because transmission principles say everything that their closure counterparts say (and more besides).

Epistemic closure principles likewise can be true when their transmission counterparts are false.

Simple Closure: If S knows that P and deduces Q from P, then S knows that Q.

Simple Transmission: If S knows that P and deduces Q from P, then S knows that Q in virtue of knowing that P.

Even supposing Simple Closure is true (which it probably is not), Simple Transmission is false.  Suppose S knows Q on the basis of perceptual experience and then comes to know P on the basis of her knowing Q.  It would be premise circular if she then also based her belief in Q on her belief in P.  If she did so, her extended argument would be Q therefore P therefore Q.  It is plausible in such a case that S still knows the conclusion Q on the basis of the relevant perceptual experience.  Assuming she still knows Q, her deduction from P to Q is not a counterexample to Simple Closure.  On the other hand, this case is a clear counterexample to Simple Transmission.  Although she knows Q, she knows it in virtue of the perceptual experience, not deducing it from her knowledge that P.

The difference between closure and transmission principles was just explained.  Next, the difference between closure and transmission failure will be explained.  There is an instance of closure failure when Pa and Rab hold, but Pb does not.  Simple Closure suffers from closure failure just in case someone deduces Q from her knowledge that P but nonetheless fails to know that Q.  An instance of simple closure failure just is a counterexample to Simple Closure.

There is an instance of transmission failure whenever it is false that Pb in virtue of Pa and Rab.  There are three types of transmission failure which correspond to the three ways in which it might be false that Pb holds in virtue of Pa and Rab.  The first type occurs just in case either Pa or Rab does not hold.  If Pa and Rab do not hold, then Pb cannot hold in virtue of Pa and Rab.  Consequently, Rab would fail to transmit P from a to b.  Notice that this first type of transmission failure can occur even if the relevant transmission principle is true.  Transmission principles do not say that Pa and Rab in fact hold; instead they say if Pa and Rab hold, then Pb holds in virtue of Pa and Rab.  If S fails to know P or fails to deduce Q from P, then the deduction fails to transmit knowledge from P to Q.  Nonetheless, Simple Transmission might still be true, because it does not demand that S actually deduce Q from her knowledge that P.  A similar point explains why one can have type-one transmission failure without having closure failure, that is, without having a counterexample to the corresponding closure principle.  There is, therefore, an interesting difference between transmission and closure failure: an instance of closure failure just is a counterexample to some relevant closure principle, but an instance of transmission failure need not be a counterexample to some relevant transmission principle.

Although the first type of transmission failure never provides a counterexample to some relevant transmission principle, the second and third types always provide such a counterexample. The second type occurs just in case Pa and Rab holds but Pb does not—precisely the same circumstances in which closure failure occurs.  In other words, the second type of transmission failure occurs just in case closure failure does.  It follows that all instances of closure failure are instances of transmission failure.  It does not follow, however, that all instances of transmission failure are instances of closure failure: there will be transmission failure without closure failure whenever there is transmission failure of the first or third types.  Simple Transmission suffers from type-two transmission failure (and closure failure) just in case S deduces Q from her knowledge that P but nonetheless fails to know Q.  (The idea that all instances of closure failure are instances of transmission failure but not vice versa also follows from the fact that transmission principles say everything that their closure counterparts say and more besides.  By saying everything that closure principles say, transmission principles will fail whenever their closure counterparts do.  By saying more than their closure counterparts, they sometimes will fail even when their closure counterparts do not.)

The third type of transmission failure occurs just in case Pa, Rab, and Pb hold, but Pb does not hold in virtue of Pa and Rab.  Since closure principles do not demand that Pb hold in virtue of Pa and Rab, a closure principle may be true even if its corresponding transmission principle suffers from type-three transmission failure.  Simple Transmission suffers from type-three transmission failure just in case S deduces Q from S’s knowledge that P, S knows Q, but S does not know Q in virtue of the deduction from her knowledge that P.  The premise circular argument discussed in this sub-section is a plausible example of this type of failure.  As was explained above, in such a case Simple Closure might hold but Simple Transmission would not.

b. The (Misplaced?) Focus on Closure

There is no doubt that, in the epistemological literature, closure failure is in some sense the bigger issue.  Some epistemological theories seem committed to rejecting intuitive closure principles, and there is extensive debate over how serious of a crime it is to reject these principles.  Although the literature on transmission failure is by no means scant, considerably more ink has been spilt over closure failure.  One naturally is inclined to infer that closure failure is the more important issue, but this may be incorrect: the literature’s focus on closure failure may be misplaced—though this potential misplacement is likely harmless.

Crispin Wright (1985: 438, nt. 1) was perhaps the first to distinguish between epistemic closure and transmission principles, but much of the literature has not observed this distinction, a fact that has been noted by Wright (2003: 76, nt.1) and Davies (2000: 394, nt. 19).  When some philosophers purport to talk about closure principles, they are really talking about transmission principles.  Consider Williamson’s “intuitive closure” principle: “knowing p1,…,pn, competently deducing q, and thereby coming to believe q is in general a way of coming to know q” (2000: 117, emphasis mine).  Closure principles can tell us that everything we competently deduce from prior knowledge itself will be known; however, only transmission principles can tell us the how, that is, that the conclusions are known in virtue of the competent deductions.  Hawthorne likewise treats closure principles as if they were transmission ones: “Our closure principles are perfectly general principles concerning how knowledge can be gained by deductive inference from prior knowledge” (2004: 36, emphasis mine).  Closure principles can tell us that everything we competently deduce from prior knowledge itself will be known; however, only transmission principles can tell us that our knowledge of these conclusions was gained by the deduction from prior knowledge.

Dretske’s 1970 paper “Epistemic Operators” introduced the epistemological world to the issue of closure failure, and his subsequent work on the topic has been extremely important.  Yet even he now admits that discussing transmission failure “provides a more revealing way” of explaining some of his key claims concerning closure failure (2005: 15).  One wonders, then, whether the literature’s greater focus on closure failure is (harmlessly?) misplaced.

c. Why Transmission is an Interesting Issue, Revisited

Although it seems salutary to appreciate the distinction between closure and transmission failure, it may be that some philosophers read too much into this distinction.  Although Wright holds that certain competent deductions are instances of transmission failure, he is “skeptical whether there are any genuine counterexamples to closure” (2002: 332; 2003: 57-8; cf. 2000: 157).  Davies seems sympathetic to a similar position at times (2000: 394) but not at others (1998: 326).  These remarks suggest the following way of explaining why transmission is an interesting issue: “Moore’s Proof seems to be a bad argument, but intuitive closure principles seem too plausible to reject.  This tension can be resolved when Moore’s Proof is treated as an instance of transmission rather than closure failure.  Moore’s Proof seems to be a bad argument and is a bad argument because it fails to transmit justification to its conclusion; it is not, however, a counterexample to intuitive closure principles.”

Smith (2009: 181) comes closest to endorsing this motivation explicitly, but even if it is not widely held, it is worth explaining why it fails.  To do so, two new closure principles need to be introduced.  Simple Closure and Simple Transmission were discussed in 4.A in order to provide a clear case in which a transmission principle is false even if its closure counterpart is true.  Yet Simple Closure is too simple to be plausible.  For example, it fails to account for defeaters (for example, relevant counterevidence).  If S deduces Q from her knowledge that P, then Simple Closure says that S knows Q.  Yet if S makes that deduction even though her total evidence supports ~Q, she will not know Q.

When philosophers defend closure principles, they typically defend, not Simple Closure, but something like:

Strong Closure: If S knows P and S competently deduces Q from P, then S knows that Q.

Simple Closure holds that knowledge is closed over deductions.  Strong Closure, on the other hand, holds that knowledge is closed over competent deductions.  Recall from 3.B that a deduction is competent just in case the premises are well justified; the premises provide deductive (so maximal) support for their conclusions; the subject knows that the premises provide deductive support; there are no relevant defeaters; and it is not premise circular.  Given that competent deductions seem, at first glance at least, to be the paradigm of good reasoning (see 3.B), it should not be surprising that philosophers defend something like Strong Closure.

The second closure principle that needs to be introduced is:

Weak Closure: If S knows P and S competently deduces Q from P, then S has some epistemic status for Q, no matter how weak.

Suppose S competently deduces Q from her knowledge that P.  Strong Closure holds that S must know Q.  Weak Closure, on the other hand, says only that S must have some positive epistemic status for Q, no matter how weak.  (It is worth noting that, despite its name, Weak Closure is not obviously a closure principle.  Closure principles say that if Pa and Rab, then Pb (see 4.A).  If there are three different epistemic properties P, Q, and R, then Weak Closure is in this form: if Pa and Rab, then Pb or Qb or Rb.  This concern can be ignored, because if Weak Closure fails to count as a closure principle, then there would only be further problems with the above motivation.)

Wright (2004), Davies (2003: 29-30), and perhaps also Smith (2009: 180-1) endorse an account of non-inferential knowledge which allows them to endorse Weak Closure but not Strong Closure.  (McLaughlin 2003: 91-2 endorses a similar view, but it is not clear that his explanation of transmission failure is compatible with even Weak Closure.)  Put simply, they hold that to have (strong) non-inferential justification for P, one must have prior entitlement for certain background assumptions.  An entitlement to some background assumption A is something like a very weak justification for A that one has automatically, or by default.  Since they suppose (as is common) that knowledge requires the strong type of justification, they also hold that non-inferential knowledge likewise requires this prior weak and default justification for background assumptions.  (The most extensive defense of this view of non-inferential justification is Wright’s 2004.  See Tucker’s 2009 for a criticism of this view as it relates to perceptual justification.)

Applied to Moore’s Proof, this view holds that, to have non-inferential knowledge that one has a hand (the premise of Moore’s Proof), she must have some prior entitlement to accept that there are material things (the conclusion of Moore’s Proof).  Since the conclusion of Moore’s Proof would not be used as a sub-premise to establish that one has hands, it would not count as premise circular.  Nonetheless, since knowing the premise would require some previous (however weak) justification for the conclusion, this view of non-inferential justification makes Moore’s Proof circular in some other sense.  Does this type of circularity prevent the premise from transmitting knowledge to the conclusion?  Wright and Davies certainly think so, but Cohen (1999:76-7, 87, nt. 52) is more optimistic.  If Wright and Davies are correct, then one has some very weak justification for the conclusion of Moore’s Proof, but they do not and cannot know this conclusion.  Since the conclusion, that there are material things, does have some weak epistemic status, Wright and Davies can endorse Weak Closure.  Yet they are forced to reject Strong Closure because they hold that one cannot know that there are material things.

The ability to endorse Weak Closure is not enough for the above way of motivating the issue of transmission failure to succeed.  Strong Closure (or some principle in the general neighborhood) is what most epistemologists find too plausible to reject.  Since Wright and Davies must reject Strong Closure, their diagnosis of Moore’s Proof cannot explain the badness of Moore’s Proof without rejecting the version of closure that most philosophers find intuitive.  (See Silins 2005: 89-95 for related discussion.)

Something like Strong Closure seems extremely plausible even to those who ultimately reject it (for example, Dretske 2005: 18).  But why does it seem so plausible?  Tucker (2010: 498-9) holds that it seems so plausible because its corresponding transmission principle seems so plausible.  Consider:

Strong Transmission: If S knows P and S competently deduces Q from P, then S knows that Q in virtue of that competent deduction.

Strong Transmission says what Strong Closure says and that the conclusion is justified in virtue of that competent deduction.  Tucker’s suggestion is that Strong Closure seems plausible because Strong Transmission seem plausible.  It seems that justification is closed over a competent deduction because it seems competent deductions must transmit justification to their conclusions, a point discussed above in section 2.B.  From this point of view, it is no surprise to find that the literature often treats closure principles as if they were transmission ones, for our intuitions concerning transmission would explain why certain closure principles seem so plausible.

5. Transmission Failure: Two Common Assumptions

It is commonly held that Moore’s Proof, the Neo-Moorean Argument, and the Zebra Argument are instances of transmission failure.  When philosophers attempt to explain why these arguments fail to transmit, they tend to make two assumptions.

a. Transmission of Warrant vs. Transmission of Justification

Much of the literature on transmission failure focuses on the transmission of warrant rather than the transmission of (doxastic) justification (see Wright 1985, 2002, 2003; Davies 1998, 2000, 2003; and Dretske 2005).  A warrant for P, roughly, is something that counts in favor of accepting P.  An evidential warrant for P is some (inferential or non-inferential) evidence that counts in favor of accepting P.  Entitlement, which was discussed in 4.B, is a type of non-evidential warrant for P, a warrant that one has by default.  One can have a warrant for P even if she does not believe P or believes P but not on the basis of the warrant.  Notice that it is propositions that are warranted relative to a person.

(Doxastic) justification, on the other hand, is a property that beliefs have.  Roughly, a belief is justified when it is held in an epistemically appropriate way.  S is justified in believing P only if (i) S has warrant for P and (ii) S’s belief in P is appropriately connected to that warrant for P.  Hence, one can have warrant for a belief even though it is not justified.  Suppose Merla has some genuine evidential warrant for her belief that Joey is innocent, so her belief satisfies (i); but her belief will not be justified if she believes that Joey is innocent solely because the Magic 8-Ball says so.  Although Merla would have warrant for Joey’s innocence, her belief in his innocence would not be connected appropriately to that warrant.  In other words, her belief would not be justified because it would not satisfy (ii).

Again, Wright, Davies, and Dretske focus on the transmission of warrant, not justification. In a representative statement, Davies maintains that “The question is whether the epistemic warrants that I have for believing the premises add up to an epistemically adequate warrant for the conclusion” (2000: 399, cf. 2003: 51). Dretske focuses more specifically on the transmission of evidential warrant.  Transmission failure, he says, is the idea “that some reasons for believing P do not transmit to things, Q, known to be implied by P” (15).  These philosophers hold that Moore’s Proof fails to transmit in the sense that it fails to make the warrant for its premise warrant for its conclusion.

These philosophers assume, however, that the failure to transmit warrant suffices for the failure to transmit justification.  In other words, they make:

Common Assumption 1: if an argument fails to transmit warrant, then it fails to transmit justification.

The difference between these two types of transmission failure is subtle.  To say that an argument fails to transmit justification is to say that an argument fails to make its conclusion justified.  To say that an argument fails to transmit warrant is to say that the argument fails to make belief in its conclusion justified in a very particular way, namely by converting warrant for the premise into warrant for the conclusion.

Davies, Wright, and, to a lesser extent, Dretske reveal this assumption when they discuss the significance of failing to transmit warrant.  Wright assumes that when an argument fails to transmit warrant, it is not an argument “whereby someone could be moved to rational [or justified] conviction of its conclusion” (2000: 140).  In one paragraph, Davies seems to suppose, at the very least, that “limitations on the transmission of epistemic warrants” suffice for “limitations on our ability to achieve knowledge [and presumably also justification] by inference” (2003: 35-6).  Although there is no one passage that illustrates this, Dretske (2005) assumes that an evidential warrant’s failing to transmit prevents knowledge (and presumably also justification) from transmitting.

This first assumption is significant because the transmission of justification seems to be the more important type of transmission. When we evaluate the quality of arguments (insofar as they are used to organize one’s beliefs) we want to know whether we can justifiably believe the conclusion in virtue of accepting the argument.  Whether an argument transmits warrant is usually relevant to this aim only insofar as it implies something about when the argument transmits justification.

Silins (2005: 87-88) and Tucker (2010: 505-7) criticize this first assumption.  Suppose that Harold’s belief in P is doxastically justified by his evidence E; he notices that P entails Q; and then he subsequently deduces Q from P.  According to Silins and Tucker, it is natural to identify Harold’s reason for accepting Q as P, not E.  Since we are supposing that P entails Q, P is presumably a warrant for Q.  But if P is Harold’s reason for Q and is itself a warrant for Q, it does not seem to matter whether the deduction transmits warrant, that is, whether the deduction makes E into a warrant for Q.  It is worth noting that, even if Common Assumption 1 is ultimately correct, Tucker and Silins still have a point: this assumption is not sufficiently obvious to be taken for granted, as Wright, Dretske, and Davies do.

b. Transmission vs. Resolving Doubt

The second common assumption may be the more important.  It says that failing to have the power to resolve doubt suffices for failing to transmit justification.  In other words:

Common Assumption 2: if an argument fails to have the power to resolve doubt, then it fails to transmit justification to its conclusion.

A deduction P therefore C has the power to resolve doubt (about its conclusion) iff it is possible for one to go from doubting C to justified belief in C solely in virtue of accepting P therefore C.  As I am using the term, one (seriously) doubts P just in case she either disbelieves or withholds judgment about P.  Withholding judgment is more than merely failing to believe or disbelieve P: it is resisting or refraining from both believing and disbelieving P, and one cannot do that unless one has considered P.

Suppose that Hillbilly has been very out of the loop the last few years, and he doubts that Obama is the president.  He then discovers that both CNN and the NY Times say that he is the president.  He might justifiably infer that, after all, Obama is the president.  This is because the argument he would accept has the power to resolve doubt.  On the other hand, the Neo-Moorean Argument, for example, does not have the power to resolve doubt.  If one doubts NM2, that she is not a brain-in-a-vat, she cannot rationally believe, NM1, that she has a hand.  So doubting the conclusion of the Neo-Moorean Argument prevents a key premise in the argument from being justified, thereby preventing the argument from justifying the conclusion.  Since the argument cannot justify its conclusion when the subject antecedently disbelieves or withholds judgment about the conclusion, it lacks the power to resolve doubt.

Wright (2002, 2003), Davies (2003), and McLaughlin (2000) make this second assumption. Wright maintains that “Intuitively, a transmissible warrant should make for the possible advancement of knowledge, or warranted belief, and the overcoming of doubt or agnosticism” (2002: 332, emphasis mine).  In another paper, he says of an example that, “The inference from A to B is thus not at the service of addressing an antecedent agnosticism about B.  So my warrant does not transmit” (2003: 63).

Davies’ (2003) Limitation Principles for the transmission of warrant are, he thinks, motivated “by making use of the idea that failure of transmission of epistemic warrant is the analogue, within the thought of a single subject, of the dialectical phenomenon of begging the question” (41).  In Davies’ view, “The speaker begs the question against the hearer if the hearer’s doubt rationally requires him to adopt background assumptions relative to which the considerations that are supposed to support the speaker’s premises no longer provide that support” (41).  Take the Zebra Argument.  If you doubted Z2, that the animal is not a cleverly disguised mule, then Davies suggests that your perceptual experience will no longer count in favor of your belief in Z1, that the animal is a zebra.  So if I offered you the Zebra Argument in order to convince you that the animal is not a cleverly disguised mule, I would beg the question against you.

It is pretty clear, as Davies’ discussion suggests, that accepting an argument that fails to be a “question-settling justification,” that is, accepting an argument lacking the power to resolve doubt, is the analogue of the dialectical phenomenon of begging the question (for example, 2003: 41-5, esp. 42).  Were I to accept the Zebra Argument when I have antecedent doubt about its conclusion, I would, as it were, beg the question against myself.  Yet Davies never provides any reason to believe that transmission failure is an analogue of begging the question.  He seems to take for granted that for something (for example, an experience or argument) to be a justification at all, it must have the power to resolve doubt.

McLaughlin’s (2000) primary concern is with the transmission of knowledge, not justification, but he seems to make a parallel assumption.  He says the Neo-Moorean Argument cannot transmit knowledge because it begs the question: “The premises fail to provide a sufficient epistemic basis on which to know the conclusion because my basis for one of the premises is dependent on the truth of the conclusion in such a way as to render the argument question begging” (104).  It is Neo-Moorean Argument’s inability to resolve doubt that makes it question-begging.  Hence, McLaughlin seems to assume that the power to resolve doubt is required for the power to make a conclusion known.

Much of the literature on transmission failure, then, operates on the assumption that the power to justify requires the power to resolve doubt.  Taking this assumption for granted was probably a reasonable thing to do at the time the literature was first published; however, this assumption is now challenged most directly by Pryor (2004), but Markie (2005: 409) and Bergmann (2006: 198-200) challenge similar assumptions in connection with easy knowledge and epistemic circularity, respectively.  Although Davies initially endorses Common Assumption 2, he seems inclined to reject it in his later work (2004: 242-3).  Those who challenge this assumption first emphasize (though not necessarily in these words) the conceptual distinction between transmission failure and the inability to resolve doubt, and then they contend that we need some special reason to think that the inability to resolve doubt suffices for transmission failure.

Sometimes philosophers press similar distinctions in different terminology, and it is worth explaining the connection with one other popular way of talking.  Some (for example, Pryor 2004: 369) hold that Moore’s Proof can transmit justification even though it is dialectically ineffective for some audiences.  An argument is dialectically effective for an audience when it is one that will transmit justification (knowledge) to the argument’s conclusion given the audience’s current beliefs, experiences, and other epistemically relevant factors.  Consider again Hillbilly’s argument that Two reliable sources, namely CNN and NY Times, say that Obama is the president; therefore, Obama is the president.  This argument is dialectically effective for Hillbilly because he has no antecedent doubt about the reliability of CNN and NY Times.  This same argument nonetheless may be dialectically ineffective for his cousin if the cousin antecedently doubts (rationally or irrationally) the reliability of these two news outlets.  Before this argument will be dialectically effective for the cousin, her antecedent doubt must be resolved.

Defenders of Moore’s Proof sometimes say that the “proof” is dialectically effective for audiences that lack antecedent doubt in the argument’s conclusion that there are no material things, but not for its intended audience, namely those skeptical of this conclusion.  Moore’s Proof fails to be dialectically effective for this skeptical audience because such skeptics tend to doubt the reliability of perception.

Appreciating the distinction between transmission failure and the inability to resolve doubt (or dialectical effectiveness) not only casts doubt on Common Assumption 2, but also provides proponents of Moore’s Proof with an error theory.  In general, an error theory attempts to explain why something seems true when it is not.  The proponent of Moore’s Proof wants to explain why Moore’s Proof seems to be an instance of transmission failure when it is not.  In other words, this error theory attempts to explain away the intuition that Moore’s Proof is an instance of transmission failure.  The proponent of this error theory will say that this intuition is partly right and partly wrong.  What it gets right is that Moore’s Proof exhibits a genuine failure, namely the failure to resolve doubt (and/or be dialectically effective for its target audience).  What it gets wrong is that Moore’s Proof is an instance of transmission failure.  Yet, since it is easy to conflate the two types of failure, it is easy to mistakenly think that Moore’s Proof is an instance of transmission failure too.

The success of this error theory depends on at least two factors.  The first is whether transmission failure and the inability to resolve doubt are in fact easily confused.  This seems plausible given the widespread tendency to implicitly endorse Common Assumption 2 without comment.  The second is whether one retains the intuition that Moore’s Proof is an instance of transmission failure.  If, after considering this error theory and carefully distinguishing transmission failure from the inability to resolve doubt, one no longer has the intuition that Moore’s Proof is a bad argument, then the error theory seems promising.  If, however, one retains the intuition that Moore’s Proof is a bad argument, it is far less plausible that the intuition of transmission failure arises from conflating transmission failure with the inability to resolve doubt.  Consequently, the error theory would seem considerably less promising.  (Wright 2008 responds to Pryor’s version of this error theory, a response which is criticized by Tucker’s 2010: 523-4.)

6. References and Further Reading

  • Bergmann, Michael. 2006. Justification without Awareness. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
    • In Chapter 7, Bergmann makes a distinction similar to the transmission/resolving doubt distinction and uses it to defend some instances of epistemic circularity.
  • Cohen, Stewart. 1999. “Contextualism, Skepticism, and the Structure of Reasons.” Philosophical Perspectives 13: 57-89.
    • Cohen’s main goal is to defend epistemic contextualism, but he also seems to approve of a type of circularity that Davies and Wright find vicious (see 76-7, 87, nt. 52).
  • Davies, Martin. 2004. “Epistemic Entitlement, Warrant Transmission, and Easy Knowledge.” Aristotelian Society Supplementary Volume 78: 213-45.
    • In this paper, Davies distances himself from his earlier work on transmission failure and seems sympathetic to the error theory discussed in 5.B.
  • Davies, Martin. 2003. “The Problem of Armchair Knowledge.” In Nuccetelli 23-56.
    • In this paper, Davies defends his early views concerning transmission failure, but perhaps its most useful contribution is that it considers a wide variety of cases that he holds are instances of transmission failure (see especially section 5).
  • Davies, Martin. 2000. “Externalism and Armchair Knowledge.” In Boghossian, Paul and Christopher Peacocke (eds.) 384-414.
    • This paper is probably the place to start for those interested in Davies’ early views on transmission failure.
  • Davies, Martin. 1998. “Externalism, Architecturalism, and Epistemic Warrant.” In Wright, Crispin, C. Smith, and C. Macdonald (eds.). Knowing Our Own Minds. Oxford: Oxford University Press, pgs. 321- 361.
    • Davies presents his initial views on transmission failure, which he refines in his 2000 and 2003 and then apparently reconsiders in his 2004.
  • Dretske, Fred. 2005. “The Case against Closure.” In Steup, Matthias and Ernest Sosa (eds.). Contemporary Debates in Epistemology. Malden: Blackwell Publishing, 13-25.
    • Dretske defends his view that closure principles are false, and, in sec. 1, he explains how some of what he says about closure failure in his earlier work can be better expressed in terms of transmission failure.
  • Dretske, Fred. 1970. “Epistemic Operators” Journal of Philosophy 67: 1007-23.
    • Dretske introduces closure failure as an issue for discussion, but his 2005 provides a simpler introduction to the closure failure issue.
  • Hawthorne, John. 2005. “The Case for Closure.” In Steup, Matthias and Ernest Sosa (eds.). Contemporary Debates in Epistemology. Malden: Blackwell Publishing, 26-42.
    • Hawthorne defends intuitive closure principles and criticizes Dretske’s views regarding closure (and transmission) failure.
  • Lackey, Jennifer. 2006.  “Introduction.” In Lackey, Jennifer and Ernest Sosa (eds.). The Epistemology of Testimony. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
    • In Section 3, Lackey briefly discusses some of the transmission issues concerning testimony.
  • Markie, Peter J. “Easy Knowledge.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 70: 406-16.
    • Markie discusses some competent deductions that seem to be instances of transmission failure (though he does not use that terminology), and he provides an error theory of the sort discussed in section 5.B above.
  • McKinsey, Michael. 2003. “Transmission of Warrant and Closure of Apriority.”
    • In Nuccetelli 97-115.  McKinsey responds to Wright (2000) and Davies’ (1998, 2000, 2003) charge that McKinsey’s Paradox is an instance of transmission failure.
  • McLaughlin, Brian. 2003. “McKinsey’s Challenge, Warrant Transmission, and Skepticism.”  In Nuccetelli 79-96.
    • McLaughlin provides an objection to Wright’s 2000 conditions for transmission failure, which convinces Wright to modify those conditions in his later work.  It also provides a careful discussion of whether McKinsey’s Paradox is an instance of transmission failure.
  • McLaughlin, Brian. 2000. “Skepticism, Externalism, and Self-Knowledge.” The Aristotelian Society Supplementary Volume 74: 93-118.
    • On pages 104-5, McLaughlin connects transmission failure with question-begging and claims that the Neo-Moorean argument is an instance of transmission failure.
  • Nuccetelli, Susana (ed.). 2003. New Essays on Semantic Externalism and Self-Knowledge. Cambridge: MIT Press.
    • Several chapters of this collection were referenced in this article.
  • Pryor, James. 2004. “What’s Wrong with Moore’s Argument.” Philosophical Issues 14: 349-77.
    • Pryor defends Moore’s Proof from the charge of transmission failure, which includes a very careful discussion of the error theory discussed in 5.B.
  • Silins, Nicholas. 2005. “Transmission Failure Failure.” Philosophical Studies 126: 71-102.
    • Silins defends the Zebra Argument from the charge of transmission failure and provides detailed criticisms of the views of Wright and Davies.
  • Smith, Martin. 2009. “Transmission Failure Explained.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 79: 164-89.
    • Smith provides an account of transmission failure in terms of safety and reliability.  A full appreciation of Smith’s view requires at least some background in modal logic, particularly with counterfactuals, or subjunctive conditionals.
  • Tucker, Chris. 2010. “When Transmission Fails.” Philosophical Review 119: 497-529.
    • Tucker defends the Neo-Moorean and Zebra arguments by developing and defending a very permissive account of transmission failure. Much of this entry is merely a simplified version of the first half of Tucker’s 2010 paper.
  • Tucker, Chris. 2009. “Perceptual Justification and Warrant by Default.”  Australasian Journal of Philosophy 87: 445-63.
    • This paper attacks the view of non-inferential justification that Wright, and, to a lesser extent, Smith, Davies, and McLaughlin (2003) assume in their work on transmission failure.
  • Williamson, Timothy. 2000. Knowledge and Its Limits. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
    • This book contains some important work on closure failure that is equally work on transmission failure.
  • Wright, Crispin. 2008. “The Perils of Dogmatism.” Themes from G. E. Moore: New Essays in Epistemology and Ethics. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 25-48.
    • Wright criticizes an alternative to his account of non-inferential justification and, on page 38, he criticizes Pryor’s version of the error theory discussed in 5.B.
  • Wright, Crispin. 2004. “Warrant for Nothing (and Foundations for Free)?” Aristotelian Society Supplementary Volume 78: 167- 212.
    • Wright’s extended defense of his account of non-inferential justification.
  • Wright, Crispin. 2003. “Some Reflections on the Acquisition of Warrant by Inference.” In Nuccetelli 57-78.
    • The place to start for those interested in understanding Wright’s account of transmission failure as it relates to McKinsey’s Paradox and content externalism.
  • Wright, Crispin. 2002. “(Anti)-Sceptics Simple and Subtle: G. E. Moore and John McDowell.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 65: 330-348.
    • The place to start for those interested in Wright’s account of transmission failure as it relates to perceptual justification.
  • Wright, Crispin. 2000. “Cogency and Question-Begging: Some Reflections on McKinsey’s Paradox and Putnam’s Proof.” Philosophical Issues 10: 140-63.
    • Wright provides a transmission failure principle which he refines in his 2002 and 2003 in light of McLaughlin’s 2003 criticism.
  • Wright, Crispin. 1985. “Facts and Certainty.” Proceedings of the British Academy, 429-472. Reprinted in Williams, Michael (ed.). 1993. Skepticism. Aldershot: Dartmouth Publishing Company Limited, pgs. 303-346.
    • Wright’s earliest work on transmission failure and perhaps the first paper to distinguish between closure and transmission principles.  Since Wright’s main focus is not transmission failure, you might start with one of Wright’s later papers unless one is very interested in the full details of Wright’s broadly Wittgensteinian epistemology.

Author Information

Chris Tucker
Email: c.tucker@auckland.ac.nz
University of Auckland
New Zealand

Fictionalism in the Philosophy of Mathematics

The distinctive character of fictionalism about any discourse is (a) recognition of some valuable purpose to that discourse, and (b) the claim that that purpose can be served even if sentences uttered in the context of that discourse are not literally true. Regarding (b), if the discourse in question involves mathematics, either pure or applied, the core of the mathematical fictionalist’s view about such discourse is that the purpose of engaging in that discourse can be served even if the mathematical utterances one makes in the context of that discourse are not true (or, in the case of negative existentials such as ‘There are no square prime numbers’, are only trivially true).

Regarding (a), in developing mathematical fictionalism, then, mathematical fictionalists must add to this core view at the very least an account of the value of mathematical inquiry and an explanation of why this value can be expected to be served if we do not assume the literal or face-value truth of mathematics.

The label ‘fictionalism’ suggests a comparison of mathematics with literary fiction, and although the fictionalist may wish to draw only the minimal comparison that both mathematics and fiction can be good without being true, fictionalists may also wish to develop this analogy in further dimensions, for example by drawing on discussions of the semantics of fiction, or on how fiction can represent. Before turning to these issues, though, this article considers what the literal truth of a sentence uttered in the context of mathematical inquiry would amount to, so as to understand the position that fictionalists wish to reject.

Table of Contents

  1. Face-value Semantics, Platonism, and its Competitors
  2. The Fictionalist’s Attitude: Acceptance without Belief
  3. Preface or Prefix Fictionalism?
  4. Mathematical Fictionalism and Empirical Theorizing
    1. Mathematical Fictionalism + Scientific Realism
    2. Mathematical Fictionalism + Nominalistic Scientific Realism
    3. Mathematical Fictionalism + Constructive Empiricism (Bueno)
  5. Hermeneutic or Revolutionary Fictionalism
  6. References and Further Reading

1. Face-value Semantics, Platonism, and its Competitors

In the context of quite ordinary mathematical theorizing we find ourselves uttering sentences whose literal or ‘face-value’ truth would seem to require the existence of mathematical objects such as numbers, functions, or sets.  Thus: ‘2 is an even number’ appears to be of subject-predicate form, with the singular term ‘2’ purporting to stand for an object which is said to have the property of being an even number.  ‘The empty set has no members’ uses a definite description, and at least since Russell presented his theory of definite descriptions it has standardly been assumed that the truth of such sentences requires, at a minimum, the existence and uniqueness of something satisfying the indefinite descriptive phrase ‘is an empty set’.  Most stark, though, is the use of the existential quantifier in the sentences used to express our mathematical theories.  Euclid proved a theorem whose content we would express by means of the sentence ‘There are infinitely many prime numbers’.  One would have to make some very fancy manoeuvres indeed to construe this sentence as requiring anything less than the existence of numbers – infinitely many of them. (For an argument against the ‘ontologically committing’ reading of ‘there is’, see Jody Azzouni (2004: 67), according to which ‘there is’ in English functions as an ‘ontologically neutral anaphora’.  Azzouni’s position on ontological commitments is discussed helpfully in Joseph Melia’s (2005) online review of Azzouni’s book.  For the remainder of this article, though, we will assume, contrary to Azzouni’s position, that the literal truth of sentences of the form ‘there are Fs’ requires the existence of Fs.)

Similar points about the ‘face-value’ commitments of our ordinary utterances can be made if we move outside of the context of pure mathematics to sentences uttered in the context of ordinary day-to-day reasoning, or in the context of empirical science.  As Hilary Putnam (1971) famously pointed out, in stating the laws of our scientific theories we make use of sentences that, at face value, are dripping with commitments to mathematical objects.  Thus, Newton’s law of universal gravitation says that, between any two massive objects a and b there is a force whose magnitude F is directly proportional to the product of the masses ma and mb of those objects and inversely proportional to the square of the distance d between them (F = Gmamb/d2).  Unpacking this statement a little bit we see that it requires that, corresponding to any massive object o there is a real number mo representing its mass as a multiple of some unit of mass; corresponding to any distance between two objects there is a real number d representing that distance as a multiple of some unit of distance; and corresponding to any force there is a real number F representing the magnitude of that force as a multiple of some unit of force.  So, conjoined with the familiar truth that there are massive objects, the literal truth of Newton’s law requires not only that there be forces acting on these objects, and distances separating them, but that there be real numbers corresponding appropriately to masses, forces, and distances, and related in such a way that F = Gmamb/d2.  So Newton’s law taken literally requires the existence of real numbers and of correspondences of objects with real numbers (i.e., functions).

These examples show that, on a literal or face-value reading, some of the sentences used to express our mathematical and scientific theories imply the existence of mathematical objects.  The theories that are expressed by means of such sentences are thus said to be ontologically committed to mathematical objects.  Furthermore, if we interpret these sentences at face value, and if we endorse those sentences when so interpreted (accepting them as expressing truths on that face value interpretation), then it seems that we too, by our acceptance of the truth of such sentences, are committed to an ontology that includes such things as numbers, functions, and sets.

Mathematical realists standardly endorse a face-value reading of those sentences used to express our mathematical and scientific theories, and accept that such sentences so interpreted express truths.  They therefore commit themselves to accepting the existence of mathematical objects.  In inquiring into the nature of the objects to which they are thereby committed, mathematical platonists typically go on to state that the objects to which they are committed are abstract, where this is understood negatively to mean, at a minimum, non-spatiotemporal, acausal, and mind-independent.  But many philosophers are wary of accepting the existence of objects of this sort, not least because (as Benacerraf  (1973) points out) their negative characterization renders it difficult, if not impossible, to account for our ability to have knowledge of such things.  And even without such specific epistemological worries, general ‘Ockhamist’ tendencies warn that we should be wary of accepting the existence of abstract mathematical objects unless the assumption that there are such things proves to be unavoidable.  For many philosophers then, fictionalists included, mathematical platonism presents itself as a last resort – a view to be adopted only if no viable alternative that does not require belief in the existence of abstract mathematical objects presents itself.

What, then, are the alternatives to platonism?  One might reject the face-value interpretation of mathematical sentences, holding that these sentences are true, but that their truth does not (despite surface appearances) require the existence of mathematical objects.  Defenders of such an alternative must provide a method for reinterpreting those sentences of mathematical and empirical discourse that appear to imply the existence of abstract mathematical objects so that, when so-interpreted, these implications disappear.  Alternatively, one might accept the face-value semantics, but reject the truth of the sentences used to express our mathematical theories.  Assuming that it is an advantage of standard platonism that it provides a standard semantics for the sentences used to express our mathematical theories, and that it preserves our intuition that many of these sentences assert truths, each of these options preserves one advantage at the expense of another.  A final alternative is to reject both the face-value interpretation of mathematical sentences and to reject the truth of mathematical sentences once reinterpreted.  This apparently more drastic response is behind at least one position in the philosophy of mathematics that reasonably calls itself fictionalist (Hoffman (2004), building on Kitcher (1984); Hoffman’s claim is that ordinary mathematical utterances are best interpreted as making claims about the collecting and segregating abilities of a (fictional) ideal mathematician.   These claims are not literally true, since the ideal mathematician does not really exist, but there is a standard for correctness for such claims, given by the ‘story’ provided of the ideal agent and his abilities).  However, the label ‘fictionalism’ in the philosophy of mathematics is generally used to pick out positions of the second kind, and that convention will be adhered to in what follows.  That is, according to mathematical fictionalists, sentences of mathematical and mathematically-infused empirical discourse should be interpreted at face value as implying the existence of mathematical objects, but we should not accept that such sentences so-interpreted express truths.  As such, mathematical fictionalism is an error theory with respect to ordinary mathematical and empirical discourse.

2. The Fictionalist’s Attitude: Acceptance without Belief

At a minimum, then, mathematical fictionalists accept a face-value reading of sentences uttered in the context of mathematical and ordinary empirical theorizing, but when those sentences are, on that reading, committed to the existence of mathematical objects, mathematical fictionalists do not accept those sentences to be true.   Some fictionalists, e.g., Field (1989, 45) will go further than this and say that we ought to reject such sentences as false, taking it to be undue epistemic caution to maintain agnosticism rather than rejecting the existence of mathematical objects once it is recognized that we have no reason to believe that there are such things.  Whether one follows Field in rejecting the existence of mathematical objects will depend on one’s motivation for fictionalism.  A broadly naturalist motivation, according to which we should accept the existence of all and only those objects whose existence is confirmed according to our best scientific standards, would seem to counsel disbelief.  On the other hand, fictionalists who reach that position from a starting point of constructive empiricism will take the agnosticism about the unobservable endorsed by that position to apply also in the mathematical case.  Either way, though, fictionalists will agree that one ought not accept the truth of sentences that, on a literal reading, are committed to the existence of mathematical objects.

But simply refusing to accept the truth of sentences of a discourse does not amount to fictionalism with respect to that discourse: one may, for example, refuse to accept the truth-at-face-value of sentences uttered by homeopaths in the context of their discourse concerning homeopathic medicine, but doing so would be indicative of a healthy scepticism rather than a fictionalist approach to the claims of homeopathy.  What is distinctive about fictionalism is that fictionalists place some value on mathematical theorizing: they think that there is some valuable purpose to engaging in discourse apparently about numbers, functions, sets, and so on, and that that purpose is not lost if we do not think that the utterances of our discourse express truths.

Mathematical fictionalists, while refusing to accept the truth of mathematics, do not reject mathematical discourse.  They do not want mathematicians to stop doing mathematics, or empirical scientists to stop doing mathematically-infused empirical science. Rather, they advocate taking an attitude sometimes called acceptance to the utterances of ordinary mathematical discourse.  That is, they advocate making full use of those utterances in one’s theorizing without holding those utterances to be true (an attitude aptly described by Chris Daly (2008, 426) as exploitation). It is, therefore, rather misleading that the locus classicus of mathematical fictionalism is entitled Science without Numbers.  As we will see below, much of Field’s efforts in Science without Numbers are focussed on explaining why scientists can carry on exploiting the mathematically-infused theories they have always used, without committing themselves to the truth of the mathematics assumed by those theories.

The reasonableness of an attitude of acceptance or exploitation rather than belief will depend on the mathematical fictionalist’s analysis of the purpose of mathematical theorizing: what advantages are gained by speaking as if mathematical sentences are true, and are these advantages ones that we can reasonably expect to remain if the sentences of mathematical discourse are not in fact true?  But even prior to consideration of this question, it has been questioned (e.g., by Horwich (1991), and O’Leary-Hawthorne (1994)) whether adopting the proposed attitude of mere acceptance without belief is even possible, given that, plausibly, one’s belief states are indicated by one’s propensities to behave in a particular way, and fictionalists advocate behaving ‘as if’ they are believers, when engaging in a discourse they purport to accept. (These objections are aimed at Bas van Fraassen’s constructive empiricism (van Fraassen 1980), but apply equally well to fictionalists who do not believe our standard mathematical and scientific theories but similarly wish to continue to immerse themselves in ordinary mathematical and scientific activity, despite their reservations.)  Daly (2008) responds to this objection on the fictionalist’s behalf.

3. Preface or Prefix Fictionalism?

Mathematical fictionalists choose to speak ‘as if’ there are numbers, even though they do not believe that there are such things.  How should we understand their ‘disavowal’?  As David Lewis (2005: 315) points out, “There are prefixes or prefaces (explicit or implicit) that rob all that comes after of assertoric force.  They disown or cancel what follows, no matter what that may be.”, and we might imagine mathematical fictionalists as implicitly employing a prefix or preface that stops them from asserting, when doing mathematics, what they readily deny as metaphysicians.  The difference between a prefix and a preface is that “When the assertoric force of what follows is cancelled by a prefix, straightaway some other assertion takes place… Not so for prefaces.”  (ibid. 315)  Thus, preceding the sentence ‘Holmes lived at 221B Baker Street)’ with the prefix ‘According to the Sherlock Holmes stories…’ produces another sentence with assertoric force, whose force is not disowned.  On the other hand, preceding that very same sentence with the preface ‘Let’s make believe the Holmes stories are true, though they aren’t.’ one is not making a further assertion, but rather indicating that one is stepping back from the business of making assertions.

When mathematical fictionalists speak ‘as if’ there are numbers, can we, then, read them as implicitly employing a disowning prefix or preface?  When they utter the sentence ‘There are infinitely many prime numbers’, should we ‘hear’ them as really having begun under their breath with the prefix ‘According to standard mathematics…’, or as having prefaced their utterance with a mumbled: ‘Let’s make believe that the claims of standard mathematics are true, though they aren’t’?  Either reading is possible, but a prefix fictionalism would make the mathematical fictionalist’s insistence on a standard semantics for ordinary mathematical utterances rather less distinctive.  The claim that we have no reason to believe that ordinary mathematical utterances taken at face-value are true, but that the addition of an appropriate prefix transforms them into true claims may be correct, but does not sufficiently distinguish fictionalism so-construed from those reinterpretive anti-Platonist views that simply hold that that ordinary mathematical sentences should be given a non-standard semantics according to which they assert truths.  For example, Geoffrey Hellman’s modal structuralism holds that a mathematical sentence S uttered in the context of a mathematical theory T should be read as essentially ‘saying’: ‘T is consistent and it follows from the axioms of T that S’ (or, in other words, ‘According to (the consistent axioms of) a standard mathematical theory, S’, which is the result of applying a plausible fictionalist prefix to S).  Whether or not one reads this prefix into the semantics of mathematical claims or advocates a standard semantics but places all the value of ‘speaking as if’ there are mathematical objects on the possibility of construing one’s utterances as so-prefixed is arguably a matter of taste.

To take seriously the mathematical fictionalist’s insistence on a standard semantics, then, it is perhaps better to view mathematical fictionalists as implicitly or explicitly preceding their mathematical utterances with a disavowing preface which excuses them from the business of making assertions when they utter sentences whose literal truth would require the existence of mathematical objects.  But this, of course, raises the question of what they think they are doing when they engage, as fictionalists, in mathematical theorizing (both in the context of pure mathematics and in the context of empirical science). Pure mathematics does not present a major difficulty here – fictionalists may, for example, view the purpose of speaking as if the assumptions of our mathematical theories as true to be to enable us easily to consider what follows from those assumptions.  Pure mathematical inquiry can then be considered as speculative inquiry into what would be true if our mathematical assumptions were true, without concern about the question of whether those assumptions are in fact true, and it is perfectly reasonable to carry out such inquiry as one would a conditional proof, taking mathematical axioms as undischarged assumptions.  But in the context of empirical science this answer is not enough.  In empirical scientific theorizing we require that at least some of our theoretical utterances (minimally, those that report or predict observations) to be true, and part of the purpose of engaging in empirical scientific theorizing is to justify our unconditional assertion of the empirical consequences of our theories.  Despite the mathematical fictionalist’s disavowing preface, insulating them from the business of making assertions when they utter mathematical sentences in the context of their empirical theorizing, they are not, and would not want to be, entirely excused from the business of assertion.  The most pressing problem for mathematical fictionalists is to explain why they are licensed to endorse the truth of some, and only some, utterances made in the context of ordinary, mathematically-infused, empirical theorizing.

4. Mathematical Fictionalism and Empirical Theorizing

As we have already noted, our ordinary empirical theorizing is mathematical through and through.  We use mathematics in stating the laws of our scientific theories, in describing and organising the data to which those theories are applied, and in drawing out the consequences of our theoretical assumptions.  If we believe that the mathematical assumptions utilized by those theories are true, and also believe any non-mathematical assumptions we make use of, then we have no difficulty justifying our belief in any empirical consequences we validly derive from those assumptions: if the premises of our arguments are true then the truth of the conclusions we derive will be guaranteed as a matter of logic.  On the other hand, though, if we do not believe the mathematical premises in our empirical arguments, what reason have we to believe their conclusions?

Different versions of mathematical fictionalism take different approaches to answer this question, depending on how realist they wish to be about our scientific theories.  In particular, mathematical fictionalism can be combined with scientific realism (Hartry Field); with ‘nominalistic scientific realism’, or entity realism (Mark Balaguer, Mary Leng); and with constructive empiricism (Otávio Bueno).  We will consider these combinations separately.

a. Mathematical Fictionalism + Scientific Realism

I will here reserve the label ‘scientific realism’ for the Putnam-Boyd formulation of the view.  In Putnam’s words (1975: 73), scientific realists in this sense hold “that terms typically refer… that the theories accepted in mature science are typically approximately true, [and] that the same terms can refer to the same even when they occur in different theories”.  It is the first two parts of Putnam’s tripartite characterization that are particularly problematic for mathematical fictionalists, the first suggesting a standard semantics and the second a commitment to the truth of scientific theories.  If our mature scientific theories include, as Putnam himself contends that they do, statements whose (approximate) truth would require the existence of mathematical objects, then the combination of scientific realism with mathematical fictionalism seems impossible.

If one accepts scientific realism so-formulated, then what prospects are there for mathematical fictionalism?  The only room for manoeuvre comes with the notion of a mature scientific theory.  Certainly, in formulating the claims of our ordinary scientific theories we make use of sentences whose literal truth would require the existence of mathematical objects.  But we also make use of sentences whose literal truth would require the existence of ideal objects such as point masses or continuous fluids, and we generally do not take our use of such sentences to commit us to the existence of such objects.  Quine’s view is that, in our best, most careful expressions of mature scientific theories, sentences making apparent commitments to such objects will disappear in favour of literally true alternatives that carry with them no such commitments.  That is, we are not committed to point masses or continuous fluids because these theoretical fictions can be dispensed with in our best formulation of these mature theories.  Hartry Field, who wishes to combine scientific realism with mathematical fictionalism, thinks that the same can be said for the mathematical objects to which our ordinary scientific theories appear to be committed: in our best expressions of those theories, sentences whose literal truth would require the existence of such objects can be dispensed with.

Hence, the so-called ‘indispensability argument’ for mathematical platonism, and Field’s scientific realist response to this argument:

P1 (Scientific Realism): We ought to believe that the sentences used to express our best (mature) scientific theories, when taken at face value, are true or approximately true.

P2 (Indispensability):  Sentences whose literal truth would require the existence of mathematical objects are indispensable to our best formulations of our best scientific theories.

Therefore:

C (Mathematical Platonism): We ought to believe in the existence of mathematical objects.

(For an alternative formulation of the argument, and defence, see Colyvan (2001).)  In his defence of mathematical fictionalism, Field rejects P2, arguing that we can dispense with commitments to mathematical objects in our best formulations of our scientific theories.  In Science without Numbers (1980) Field makes the case for the dispensability of mathematics in Newtonian science, sketching how to formulate the claims of Newtonian gravitational theory without quantifying over mathematical objects.

But Field is a fictionalist about mathematics, not a mere skeptic about mathematically-stated theories.  That is, Field thinks that there is some value to speaking ‘as if’ there are mathematical objects, even though he does not accept that there really are such things.  The claim that we can dispense with mathematics in formulating the laws of our best scientific theories is, therefore, only the beginning of the story for Field: he also wishes to explain why it is safe for us to use our ordinary mathematical formulations of our scientific theories in our day-to-day theorizing about the world.

Field’s answer to this question is that our ordinary (mathematically-stated) scientific theories are conservative extensions of the literally true non-mathematical theories that we come to once we dispense with mathematics in our theoretical formulations.  A mathematically-stated empirical theory P is a conservative extension of a nominalistically stated theory N just in case any nominalistically stated consequence A of P is also a consequence of the nominalistic theory N.  Or, put another way, suppose we have an ordinary (mathematically-expressed, and therefore platonistic) scientific theory P and a nominalistically acceptable reformulation of that theory, N.  The nominalistically acceptable reformulation will aim to preserve P’s picture of the nonmathematical realm while avoiding positing the existence of any mathematical objects.  If this reformulation is successful, then every nonmathematical fact about the nonmathematical realm implied by P will also be implied by N.  In fact, typically, P will be identical to N + S: the combination of the nominalistic theory N with a mathematical theory S, such as set theory with nonmathematical urelements, that allows one to combine mathematical and nonmathematical vocabulary, e.g., by allowing nonmathematical vocabulary to figure in its comprehension schema.  In the case of Newtonian gravitational theory, Field makes the case for having found the appropriate theory N by sketching a proof of a ‘representation theorem’ which links up nonmathematical laws of N with laws of P that, against the backdrop of N + S, are materially equivalent to the nonmathematical laws.

Why, if we have a pair of such theories, N and P, does this give us license to believe the nonmathematical consequences of P, a theory whose truth we do not accept?  Simply because those consequences are already consequences of the preferred nominalistic theory N, which as scientific realists we take to be true or approximately true.  Our confidence in the truth of the nonmathematical consequences we draw from our mathematically stated scientific theories piggy backs on our confidence in the truth of the nonmathematical theories those theories conservatively extend.

But why, we may ask, should we bother with the mathematically-infused versions of our scientific theories if these theories simply extend our literally believed nominalistic theories by adding a body of falsehoods?  Field’s answer is that mathematics is an incredibly useful, practically (and sometimes even theoretically) indispensable tool that enables us to draw out the consequences of our nominalistic theories.  Nominalistically stated theories are unwieldy, and arguments from nominalistically stated premises to nominalistically stated conclusions, even when available, can be difficult to find and impractically long to write down.   With the help of mathematics, though, such problems can become tractable.  If we want to draw out the consequences of a body of nominalistically stated claims, we can use a ‘representation theorem’ to enable us to ascend to their platonistically stated counterparts, give a quick mathematical argument to some platonistically stated conclusions, then descend, again via the representation theorem, to nominalistic counterparts of those conclusions.  In short, following Carl G. Hempel’s image, mathematics has the function of a ‘theoretical juice extractor’ when applied to the nominalistic theory N:

Thus, in the establishment of empirical knowledge, mathematics (as well as logic) has, so to speak, the function of a theoretical juice extractor: the techniques of mathematical and logical theory can produce no more juice of factual information than is contained in the assumptions to which they are applied; but they may produce a great deal more juice of this kind than might have been anticipated upon a first intuitive inspection of those assumptions which form the raw material for the extractor. — C. G. Hempel (1945): 391

Extracting the consequences of our nominalistically stated theories ‘by hand’ is extremely time consuming (so much so as to make this procedure humanly impracticable without mathematics, as Ketland (2005) has pointed out).  Furthermore, if our nominalistic theories employ second-order logic in their formulation, some of these consequences can only be extracted with the help of mathematics (as noted by Field (1980: 115n. 30; 1985), Urquhart (1990: 151), and discussed in detail by Shapiro (1983)).  Nevertheless, despite being practically and even potentially theoretically indispensable in extracting the juice of factual information from our nominalistically stated theories, the indispensability of mathematics in this sense does not conflict with Field’s rejection of P2 of the indispensability argument as we have presented it, which requires only that we can state the assumptions of our best scientific theories in nonmathematical terms, not that we dispense with all uses of mathematics, for example in drawing out the consequences of those assumptions.

Field’s defense of fictionalism, though admirable, has its problems.  There are concerns both about Field’s dispensability claim and his conservativeness claim.  On the latter point, Shapiro objects that if our nominalistic scientific theories employ second-order logic, then the fact that mathematics is indispensable in drawing out some of the (semantic) consequences of those theories speaks against Field’s claim to have dispensed with mathematics.  As we have noted, indispensability in this sense does not affect Field’s ability to reject P2 of the original indispensability argument.  However, it does suggest a further indispensability argument that questions our license to use mathematics in drawing inferences if we do not believe that mathematics to be true.  Michael D. Resnik (1995: 169-70) expresses an argument of this form in his ‘Pragmatic Indispensability Argument’ as follows:

  1. In stating its laws and conducting its derivations science assumes the existence of many mathematical objects and the truth of much mathematics.
  2. These assumptions are indispensable to the pursuit of science; moreover, many of the important conclusions drawn from and within science could not be drawn without taking mathematical claims to be true.
  3. So we are justified in drawing conclusions from and within science only if we are justified in taking the mathematics used in science to be true.

Even if Field can dispense with mathematics in stating the laws of our scientific theories, the focus this argument places on the indispensability of mathematics in derivations, i.e., in drawing out the consequences of our scientific theories, presents a new challenge to Field’s program.

If we stick with second-order formulations of our nominalistic theories, then premise 2 of this argument is right in claiming that mathematics is indispensable to drawing out some of the consequences of these theories (in the sense that, for any consistent such theory and any sound derivation system for such a theory there will be semantic consequences of those theories that are not derivable within those theories relative to that derivation system).  But does the use of mathematics in uncovering the consequences of our theories require belief in the truth of the mathematics used?  Arguably, our reliance on, e.g., model theory in working out what follows from our nominalistic assumptions requires only that we believe in the consistency of our set theoretic models, not in the actual existence of those sets, so perhaps this form of the indispensability argument (based on the indispensability of mathematics in metalogic rather than in empirical science) can be responded to without dispensing with mathematics in such cases.  (See, e.g., Field (1984); Leng (2007).)

Field (1985: 255), though, has expressed some concerns about the second-order version of Newtonian gravitational theory developed in Science without Numbers.  Aside from the worry about the need to rely on set theory to discover the consequences of our second-order theories, there are more general concerns about the nominalistic acceptability of second-order quantification (with Quine (1970: 66), most famously, complaining that second-order logic is simply ‘set theory in sheep’s clothing’).  While there are various defences of the nominalistic cogency of second order logic available, Field’s own considered view is that second-order quantification is best avoided by nominalists.  This, however, rather complicates the account of applications given in Science without Numbers, since Field can no longer claim that our ordinary (mathematically stated) scientific theories conservatively extend their nominalistically stated counterparts.  In the equation above, what we can say is that for a first-order nominalistic theory N, and a mathematical theory S such as set theory with nonmathematical urelements, N+ S will be a conservative extension of N.  But for our ordinary mathematically stated scientific theory P, we will not be able to find an N such that N + S = P.  In fact, P will in general have ‘greater’ nominalistic content than any proposed counterpart first-order theory N does, by virtue of ruling out some ‘non-standard’ models that N will allow (effectively, because P will imply the existence in spacetime of a standard model for the natural numbers, whereas N will always admit of non-standard models).  We thus do not have the neat representation theorems that allow us to move from claims of N to equivalent claims of P that the machinery of Field’s ‘theoretical juice extractor’ requires.  As Field (2005) concedes, at best we can have partial representation theorems that allow for some match between our mathematical and nonmathematical claims, without straightforward equivalence.

Setting aside the logical machinery required by Field’s account of applications, there are also concerns about the prospects for finding genuinely nominalistic alternatives to our current scientific theories.  Field’s sketched nominalization of Newtonian gravitational theory is meant to show the way for further nominalizations of contemporary theories.  But even if Field has succeeded in making the case for there being a genuinely nominalistic alternative to standard Newtonian science (something that has been questioned by those who are concerned about Field’s postulation of the existence of spacetime points with a structure isomorphic to the 4-dimensional real space R4), many have remained pessimistic about the prospect for extending Field’s technique to further theories, for various reasons.  As Alasdair Urquhart (1990) points out, Newtonian science is very convenient in that, since it assumes that spacetime has the structure of R4, it becomes easy to find claims about relations between spacetime points that correspond to mathematical claims expressed in terms of real numbers.  But contemporary science takes spacetime to have non-constant curvature, and with the lack of an isomorphism between spacetime and R4, the prospects for finding suitable representation theorems to match mathematical claims with claims expressed solely in terms of qualitative relations between spacetime points are less clear.  Furthermore, as David Malament (1982) notes, Newtonian science is likewise convenient in that its laws primarily concern spacetime points and their properties (the mass concentrated at a point, the distance between points, etc.).  But many of our best scientific theories (such as classical Hamiltonian mechanics or quantum mechanics) are standardly expressed as phase space theories, with their laws expressing relations between the possible states of a physical system.  An analogous approach to that of Science without Numbers would dispense with mathematical expressions of these relations in favour of nonmathematical expressions of the same – but this would still leave us with an ontology of possibilia, something that would presumably be at least as problematic as an ontology of abstract mathematical objects.  As Malament (1982: 533) points out, ‘Even a generous nominalist like Field cannot feel entitled to quantify over possible dynamical states.’  And finally, as Malament further notes, the case of quantum mechanics presents even more problems, since, as well as being a phase space theory, the Hilbert space formulation represents the quantum mechanical state of a physical system as an assignment of probabilities to measurement events.  What is given a mathematical measure is a proposition or eventuality (the proposition that ‘A measurement of observable A yields a value within the set Δ’ is assigned a probability’).  But if propositions are the basic ‘objects’ whose properties are represented by the mathematical theory of Hilbert spaces, then applying an analogous approach to that of Science without Numbers would still throw up nominalistically unacceptable commitments.  For, Malament (1982: 534) asks, ‘What could be worse than propositions or eventualities’ for a nominalist such as Field?

These objections, while not conclusive, make clear just how much hard work remains for a full defense of Field’s dispensability claim.  It is not enough to rely on the sketch provided by Science without Numbers: mathematical fictionalists who wish to remain scientific realists in the Putnam-Boyd sense must show how they plan to dispense with mathematics in those cases where the analogy with Newtonian science breaks down (at a minimum, explaining how to deal with spacetime of non-constant curvature, phase space theories, and the probabilistic properties of quantum mechanics).  Mark Balaguer (1996) attempts the third of these challenges, arguing that we can dispense with quantum events just as long as we assume that there are physically real propensity properties of physical systems, an assumption that he claims to be ‘compatible with all interpretations of quantum mechanics except for hidden variables interpretations’ (Balaguer 1996, p. 217).  But there clearly remains much to be done to show that mathematical assumptions can be dispensed with in favour of nominalistically acceptable alternatives.

b. Mathematical Fictionalism + Nominalistic Scientific Realism

Despair about the prospects of completing Field’s project, as well as attention to the explanation of the applicability of mathematics that Field provides, has led some fictionalists (who, with a nod to Colyvan, I will label ‘Easy Road’ fictionalists), to wonder whether there isn’t an easier way to defend their position against the challenge of explaining why it is appropriate to trust the predictions of our mathematically-stated scientific theories if we do not believe those theories to be true.  Look again at Field’s explanation of the applicability of mathematics.  Field’s claim is, effectively, that our mathematically stated theories are predictively successful because they have a true ‘nominalistic’ core (as expressed, for theories for which we have dispensed with mathematics, by the claims of a nominalistic theory N).  What accounts for the trustworthiness of those theories is not that they are true (in their mathematical and nonmathematical parts), but that they are correct in the picture they paint of the nonmathematical realm.  Easy Road fictionalists then ask, doesn’t this explanation of the predictive success of a false theory undermine the case for scientific realism as on the Putnam/Boyd formulation?

Realists typically claim that we have to believe that our scientific theories are true or approximately true, otherwise their predictive success would be miraculous (thus, according to Putnam (1975: 73), realism ‘is the only philosophy that doesn’t make the success of science a miracle’).  But Field’s explanation of the predictive success of ordinary (mathematically stated) Newtonian science shows how that success does not depend on the truth or approximate truth of that theory, only on its having a true ‘nominalistic content’ (as expressed in the nominalistic version of the theory).  Mightn’t we use this as evidence against taking the predictive success of even those theories for which we do not have a neat nominalistic alternative to be indicative of their truth?  Perhaps those, too, may be successful not because they are true in all their parts, but simply because they are correct in the picture they paint of the nonmathematical world?  The contribution mathematical assumptions might be making to our theoretical success would then not depend on the truth of those assumptions, but merely on their ability to enable us to represent systems of nonmathematical objects.  Mathematics provides us with an extremely rich language to describe such systems; maybe it is even indispensable to this purpose.  But if all that the mathematics is doing in our scientific theories is enabling us to form theoretically amenable descriptions of physical systems, then why take the indispensable presence of mathematical assumptions used for this purpose as indicative of their truth?

Thus, Mark Balaguer (1998: 131) suggests that fictionalists should not be scientific realists in the Putnam-Boyd sense, but should instead adopt ‘Nominalistic Scientific Realism’:

the view that the nominalistic content of empirical science—that is, what empirical science entails about the physical world—is true (or mostly true—there may be some mistakes scattered through it), while its platonistic content—that is, what it entails “about” an abstract mathematical realm—is fictional.

This view depends on holding that there is a nominalistic content to our empirical theories (even if this content cannot be expressed in nominalistic terms), and that it is reasonable to believe just this content (believing that, as we might say, our empirical theories are nominalistically adequate, not that they are true).    Similar claims (about the value of our mathematically stated scientific theories residing in their accurate nominalistic content rather than in their truth) can be found in the work of Joseph Melia (2000), Stephen Yablo (2005) and Mary Leng (2010), though of these only Leng explicitly endorses fictionalism. Difficulties arise in characterising exactly what is meant by the nominalistic content of an empirical theory (or the claim that such a theory is nominalistically adequate).  Yablo compares the nominalistic content of a mathematical utterance with the ‘metaphorical content’ of figurative speech, and as with metaphorical content, it is perhaps easier to make a case for our mathematically stated empirical theories having such content than to give a formal account of what that content is (we are assuming, of course, that mathematics may be indispensable to expressing the nominalistic content of our theories, so that we cannot in general expect to be able to identify the nominalistic content of a mathematically stated empirical theory with the literal content of some related theory).

As Leng (2010) argues, the case for the combination of mathematical fictionalism with nominalistic scientific realism depends crucially on showing that the fictionalist’s proposal, to continue to speak with the vulgar in doing science, remains reasonable on the assumption that there are no mathematical objects.  That is, fictionalists must explain why they can reasonably rely on our ordinary scientific theories in meeting standard scientific goals such as the goals of providing predictions and explanations, if they do not believe in the mathematical objects posited by those theories.  Balaguer attempts such an explanation by means of his principal of causal isolation, the claim that there are no causally efficacious mathematical objects.  According to Balaguer (1998: 133),

Empirical science knows, so to speak, that mathematical objects are causally inert.  That is, it does not assign any causal role to any mathematical entity.  Thus, it seems that empirical science predicts that the behaviour of the physical world is not dependent in any way on the existence of mathematical objects.  But this suggests that what empirical science says about the physical world—that is, its complete picture of the physical world—could be true even if there aren’t any mathematical objects.

But while causal inefficacy goes a long way to explaining why the existence of mathematical objects is not required for the empirical success of our scientific theories, and especially in drawing a line between unobservable mathematical and physical posits (such as electrons), by itself the principle of causal isolation doesn’t show mathematical posits to be an idle wheel.  Not all predictions predict by identifying a cause of the phenomenon predicted, and, perhaps more crucially, not all explanations explain causally.  Balaguer suggests that, were there no mathematical objects at all, physical objects in the physical world could still be configured in just the ways our theories claim.  But if there were no mathematical objects, would that mean that we would lose any means of explaining why the world is configured the way it is?  If mathematical posits are essential to some of our explanations of the behaviour of physical systems, and if explanations have to be true in order to explain, then a fictionalist who does not believe in mathematical objects cannot reasonably endorse the kinds of explanations usually provided by empirical science.

Hence yet another indispensability argument has been developed to press ‘nominalistic scientific realists’ on this issue (see, particularly, Colyvan (2002); Baker (2005)).  Alan Baker (2009: 613) summarises the argument as follows:

The Enhanced Indispensability Argument

(1)   We ought rationally to believe in the existence of any entity that places an indispensable explanatory role in our best scientific theories.

(2)   Mathematical objects play an indispensable explanatory role in science.

(3)   Hence, we ought rationally to believe in the existence of mathematical objects.

What the fictionalist should make of this argument depends on what is meant by mathematical objects playing an ‘indispensable explanatory role’.  Let us suppose that this means that sentences whose literal truth would require the existence of mathematical objects are present amongst the explanandans of some explanations that we take to be genuinely explanatory.  Two lines of response suggest themselves: first, we may challenge the explanatoriness of such explanations, arguing that candidate such explanations are merely acting as placeholders for more basic explanations that do not assume any mathematics (effectively rejecting (2); Melia (2000, 2002) may be interpreted as taking this line; Bangu (2008) does so more explicitly).  On the other hand, we may accept that some such explanations are genuinely explanatory, but argue that the explanatoriness of the mathematics in these cases does not depend on its truth (effectively rejecting (1); this line is taken by Leng (2005), who argues that explaining the behaviour of a physical system by appeal to the mathematical features of a mathematical model of that system does not require belief in the existence of the mathematical model in question, only that the features that the model is imagined to have are appropriately tied to the actual features of the physical system in question).  Causal inefficacy does make a difference here, but in a slightly more nuanced way than Balaguer’s discussion suggests: it is hard to see how a causal explanation remains in any way explanatory for one who does not believe in the existence of the object posited as cause.  On the other hand, though, it is less clear that an explanation that appeals to the mathematically described structure of a physical system loses its explanatory efficacy if one is merely pretending or imagining that there are mathematical objects that relate appropriately to them.  As Nancy Cartwright (1983) suggests, causal explanations may be special in this regard – to the extent that nominalistic scientific realists agree with Cartwright on the limitations of inference to the best explanation, we may consider nominalistic scientific realism to be most naturally allied to ‘entity realism’, rather than realism about theories, in the philosophy of science.

c. Mathematical Fictionalism + Constructive Empiricism (Bueno)

What makes ‘nominalistic scientific realism’ a broadly ‘realist’ approach to our scientific theories is that, although its proponents do not believe such theories to be true or even approximately true (due to their mathematical commitments), in holding that our best scientific theories are broadly correct in their presentation of the nonmathematical world, they take it that we have reason to believe in the unobservable physical objects that those theories posit.  An alternative fictionalist option is the combination of mathematical fictionalism with constructive empiricism, according to which we should only believe that our best scientific theories are empirically adequate, correct in their picture of the observable world, remaining agnostic about the claims that those theories make about unobservables.  The combination of mathematical fictionalism with constructive empiricism has been defended by Otávio Bueno (2009).

While Bas van Fraassen is standardly viewed as presenting constructive empiricism as agnosticism about the unobservable physical world, it would seem straightforward that any reason for epistemic caution about theories positing unobservable physical entities should immediately transfer to a caution about theories positing unobservable mathematical entities.  As Gideon Rosen (194: 164) puts the point, abstract entities

are unobservable if anything is.  Experience cannot tell us whether they exist or what they are like.  The theorist who believes what his theories say about the abstract must therefore treat something other than experience as a source of information about what there is.  The empiricist makes it his business to resist this. So it would seem that just as he suspends judgment on what his theory says about unobservable physical objects, he should suspend judgment on what they say about the abstract domain.

This would suggest that constructive empiricism already encompasses, or at least should encompass, mathematical fictionalism, simply extending the fictionalist’s attitude to mathematical posits further to cover the unobservable physical entities posited by our theories.

Despite their natural affinity, the combination of mathematical fictionalism with constructive empiricism is not as straightforward as it may at first seem.  This is because, in characterising the constructive empiricist’s attitude of acceptance, van Fraassen appears to commit the constructive empiricist scientist to beliefs about mathematical objects.  Van Fraassen (1980: 64) adopts the semantic view of theories, and holds that a

theory is empirically adequate if it has some model such that all appearances are isomorphic to empirical substructures of that model.

To accept a theory is, for van Fraassen, to believe it to be empirically adequate, and to believe it to be empirically adequate is to believe something about an abstract mathematical model.  Thus, as Rosen (1994: 165) points out, for the constructive empiricist so-characterized,

The very act of acceptance involves the theorist in a commitment to at least one abstract object.

Bueno (2009: 66) suggests two options for the fictionalist in responding to this challenge: either reformulate the notion of empirical adequacy so that it does not presuppose abstract entities, or adopt a ‘truly fictionalist strategy’ which takes mathematical entities seriously as fictional entities, which Bueno takes (following Thomasson 1999) to be abstract artifacts, created by the act of theorizing.  This latter strategy effectively reintroduces commitment to mathematical objects, albeit as ‘non-existent things’ (Bueno 2009: 74), a move which is hard to reconcile with the fictionalist’s insistence on a uniform semantics (where ‘exists’ is held to mean exists).

5. Hermeneutic or Revolutionary Fictionalism

Each of these three versions of mathematical fictionalism can be viewed in one of two ways: as a hermeneutic account of the attitude mathematicians and scientists actually take to their theories, or as a potentially revolutionary proposal concerning the attitude one ought to take once one sees the fictionalist light.  Each version of fictionalism faces its own challenges (see, e.g., Burgess (2004) for objections to both versions, and, e.g., Leng (2005) and Balaguer (2009) for responses).  The question of whether fictionalism ought to be a hermeneutic or a revolutionary project is an interesting one, and has led at least one theorist with fictionalist leanings to hold back from wholeheartedly endorsing fictionalism.  From a broadly Quinean, naturalistic starting point, Stephen Yablo (1998) has argued that ontological questions should be answered, if at all, by considering the content of our best confirmed scientific theories.  However, Yablo notes, the sentences we use to express those theories can have a dual content – a ‘metaphorical’ content (such as the ‘nominalistic’ content of a mathematically stated empirical claim), as well as a literal content.  Working out what our best confirmed theories say involves us, Yablo thinks, in the hermeneutic project of working out what theorists mean by their theoretical utterances.  But for the more controversial cases, Yablo (1998: 257) argues, there may be no fact of the matter about whether theorists mean to assert the literal content or some metaphorical alternative.   We will often, he points out, utter a sentence S in a ‘make-the-most-of-it spirit’:

I want to be understood as meaning what I literally say if my statement is literally true… and meaning whatever my statement projects onto… if my statement is literally false.  It is thus indeterminate from my point of view whether I am advancing S’s literal content or not.

If answering ontological questions requires the possibility of completing the hermeneutic project of interpreting what theorists themselves mean by their mathematical utterances, and if (as Yablo (1998: 259) worries), the controversial mathematical utterances are permanently ‘equipoised between literal and metaphorical’ then there may be no principled way of choosing between mathematical fictionalism and platonism. Hence we have Yablo’s own reticence, in some incarnations, in endorsing mathematical fictionalism, even in the light of the acknowledged possibility of providing a fictionalist interpretation of our theoretical utterances.

6. References and Further Reading

  • Azzouni, J., (2004): Deflating Existential Consequence: A Case for Nominalism (Oxford: Oxford University Press)
  • Baker, A., (2005): ‘Are There Genuine Mathematical Explanations of Physical Phenomena?’, Mind 114: 223-38
  • Baker, A., (2009): ‘Mathematical Explanation in Science’, British Journal for the Philosophy of Science 60: 611-633
  • Balaguer, M. (1996): ‘Towards a Nominalization of Quantum Mechanics’, Mind105: 209-26.
  • Balaguer, M., (1998): Platonism and Anti-Platonism in Mathematics (Oxford: Oxford University Press)
  • Balaguer, M. (2009): ‘Fictionalism, Theft, and the Story of Mathematics’, Philosophia Mathematica 17: 131-162
  • Bangu, S., (2008): ‘Inference to the Best Explanation and Mathematical Realism’, Synthese 160: 13-20
  • Benacerraf, P., (1973): ‘Mathematical Truth’, The Journal of Philosophy 70: 661-679
  • Bueno, O., (2009): ‘Mathematical Fictionalism’, in Bueno, O. and Linnebo, Ø., eds., New Waves in Philosophy of Mathematics (Hampshire: Palgrave MacMillan): 59-79
  • Cartwright, N., (1983): How the Laws of Physics Lie (Oxford: Oxford University Press)
  • Colyvan, M., (2001): The Indispensability of Mathematics (Oxford: Oxford University Press)
  • Colyvan, M., (2002): ‘Mathematics and Aesthetic Considerations in Science’, Mind 111: 69-74
  • Daly, C., (2008): ‘Fictionalism and the Attitudes’, Philosophical Studies 139: 423-440
  • Field, H., (1980): Science without Numbers (Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press)
  • Field, H., (1984): ‘Is Mathematical Knowledge Just Logical Knowledge?’, Philosophical Review 93: 509-52.  Reprinted with a postscript in Field (1989): 79-124.
  • Field, H. (1985): ‘On Conservativeness and Incompleteness’, Journal of Philosophy 81: 239-60. Reprinted with a postscript in Field (1989): 125-46
  • Field, H., (1989): Realism, Mathematics and Modality (Oxford: Blackwell)
  • Hellman, G. (1989): Mathematics without Numbers: Towards a Modal-Structural Interpretation (Oxford: Oxford University Press)
  • Hempel, C. G. (1945): ‘On the Nature of Mathematical Truth’, American Mathematical Monthly 52: 543-56.  Reprinted in P. Benacerraf and H. Putnam, eds. (1983): Philosophy of Mathematics: Selected Readings (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press): 377-93
  • Hoffman, S. (2004): ‘Kitcher, Ideal Agents, and Fictionalism’, Philosophia Mathematica 12: 3-17
  • Horwich, P. (1991): ‘On the Nature and Norms of Theoretical Commitment’, Philosophy of Science 58: 1-14
  • Kalderon, M. E. (ed.), (2005): Fictionalism in Metaphysics (Oxford: Oxford University Press)
  • Ketland, J. (2005): ‘Some more curious inferences’, Analysis 65: 18-24
  • Kitcher, P. (1984):  The Nature of Mathematical Knowledge (Oxford: Oxford University Press)
  • Leng, M. (2005a): ‘Mathematical Explanation’, in C. Cellucci and D. Gillies, eds., Mathematical Reasoning, Heuristics and the Development of Mathematics (London: King’s College Publications); 167-89
  • Leng, M. (2005b): ‘Revolutionary Fictionalism: A Call to Arms’, Philosophia Mathematica 13: 277-293
  • Leng, M., (2010): Mathematics and Reality (Oxford: Oxford University Press)
  • Lewis, D., (2005): ‘Quasi-Realism is Fictionalism’, in Kalderon (2005): 314-321
  • Melia, J. (2000): ‘Weaseling Away the Indispensability Argument’, Mind 109: 455-79
  • Melia, J. (2002): ‘Response to Colyvan’, Mind 111: 75-79
  • Melia, J. (2004): ‘Review of Jody Azzouni, Deflating Existential Consequence: A Case for Nominalism’,  Notre Dame Philosophical Reviews 2005/08/15
  • O’Leary-Hawthorne, J. (1994): ‘What does van Fraassen’s critique of scientific realism show?’, The Monist 77: 128-145
  • Putnam, H. (1971): Philosophy of Logic (New York: Harper and Row).  Reprinted in Putnam (1979): 323-57
  • Putnam, H. (1975): ‘What is Mathematical Truth?’, Historia Mathematica 2: 529-43.  Reprinted in Putnam (1979): 60-78
  • Putnam, H. (1979): Mathematics, Matter and Method: Philosophical Papers Vol. II (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2nd ed.)
  • Quine, W. V. (1970): Philosophy of Logic (Cambridge: MA, Harvard University Press, 2nd ed., 1986)
  • Resnik, M. D. (1995): ‘Scientific vs. Mathematical Realism: The Indispensability Argument, Philosophia Mathematica 3: 166-74
  • Rosen, G. (1984): ‘What is Constructive Empiricism?’, Philosophical Studies 74: 143-78
  • Shapiro, S. (1983): ‘Conservativeness and Incompleteness’, Journal of Philosophy 80: 521-31
  • Thomas, R. (2000): ‘Mathematics and Fiction I: Identification’, Logique et Analyse 171-172: 301-340
  • Thomas, R. (2002): ‘Mathematics and Fiction II: Analogy’, Logique et Analyse 177-178: 185-228
  • Urquhart, A. (1990): ‘The Logic of Physical Theory’, in A. D. Irvine, ed., (1990): Physicalism in Mathematics (Dordrecht: Kluwer): 145-54
  • Van Fraassen, B. (1980): The Scientific Image (Oxford: Clarendon Press)
  • Yablo, S. (1998): ‘Does Ontology Rest on a Mistake?’, Aristotelian Society, Supplementary Volume 72: 228-61
  • Yablo, S. (2005): ‘The Myth of the Seven’, in Kalderon (2005): 88-115

Author Information

Mary Leng
Email: mcleng@liv.ac.uk
University of Liverpool
United Kingdom

Plato: Organicism

PlatoOrganicism is the position that the universe is orderly and alive, much like an organism. According to Plato, the Demiurge creates a living and intelligent universe because life is better than non-life and intelligent life is better than mere life. It is the perfect animal.  In contrast with the Darwinian view that the emergence of life and mind are accidents of evolution, the Timaeus holds that the universe, the world, is necessarily alive and intelligent. And mortal organisms are a microcosm of the great macrocosm.

Although Plato is most famous today for his theory of Forms and for the utopian and elitist political philosophy in his Republic, his later writings promote an organicist cosmology which, prima facie, conflicts with aspects of his theory of Forms and of his signature political philosophy. The organicism is found primarily in the Timaeus, but also in the Philebus, Statesman, and Laws.

Because the Timaeus was the only major dialogue of Plato available in the West during most of the Middle Ages, during much of that period his cosmology was assumed by scholars to represent the mature philosophy of Plato, and when many Medieval philosophers refer to Platonism they mean his organicist cosmology, not his theory of Forms. Despite this, Plato’s organicist cosmology is largely unknown to contemporary philosophers, although many scholars have recently begun to show renewed interest.

Table of Contents

  1. Introduction
    1. Whitehead’s Reading of Plato
    2. Greek Organicism
  2. Plato’s Cosmogony and Cosmology
    1. Creation of the World Animal
    2. The Mortal Organism as Microcosm of the Macrocosm
    3. Creation as Procreation
    4. Emergence of Kosmos from Chaos
  3. Relevance to Plato’s Philosophy
    1. Relevance to Plato’s Aesthetics
    2. Relevance to Plato’s Ethics
    3. Relevance to Plato’s Political Philosophy
    4. Relevance to Plato’s Account of Health and Medicine
    5. Relevance to Plato’s Theory of Forms
  4. Influence of Plato’s Cosmology
    1. Transition to Aristotle’s Organicism
    2. Importance for Contemporary Philosophy
  5. References and Further Reading
    1. Primary Sources
    2. Secondary Sources

1. Introduction

a. Whitehead’s Reading of Plato

In his 1927-28 Gifford Lectures, Whitehead (1978) makes the startling suggestion that Plato’s philosophy is akin to a philosophy of organism. This is surprising to many scholars because Plato’s signature doctrine, the theory of Forms, would seem to be as far removed from a philosophy of organism as possible. On the usual understanding of the theory of Forms, reality is divided into a perfect, eternal, unchanging, world of  Forms or universals, and a separate, finite, imperfect world of perceptible particulars, where the latter is an image of the former and is, in some obscure way, unreal, or less real, than the Forms.  Since living things requires growth and change, and since, according to the theory of Forms, these are mere images of the only genuine realities, the Forms, it would seem there can be no fundamental place for living organisms in Plato’s ontology.

The case for Whitehead’s thesis is based on Plato’s Timaeus, where he  compares the kosmos to a living organism, but also, to a lesser degree, on the Laws, Statesman, Philebus and Critias.   Since the Timaeus is concerned with the temporal world, generally thought to be denigrated by the “other-worldly” Plato, its relevance to Plato’s philosophy has been doubted.   First, the cosmology of the Timaeus is not even presented by Socrates, but by Timaeus, a 5th century Pythagorean.   Second, the Timaeus represents its organicist cosmology as a mere probable story.    Third, although Plato employs myths in most of his dialogues, these are generally combined with discursive argument, but the Timaeus is “myth from beginning to end” (Robin, 1996).   For these reasons, many scholars hold that the Timaeus represents a digression into physical speculations that have more to do with the natural sciences per se than they do with philosophy proper (Taylor, 1928).    Russell (1945) allows that the Timaeus deserves to be studied because it has had such great influence on the history of ideas, but holds that “as philosophy it is unimportant.”  The case is further complicated by the controversy over the longstanding view that the Timaeus is a later period dialogue.  For a discussion of these stylometric and chronological disputes see Kraut (1992), Brandwood (1992), and Meinwald (1992).

It is worth remembering, however, that throughout most of the Middle Ages, the Timaeus was the only Platonic dialogues widely available in the West and most scholars at that time assumed that it represents Plato’s mature views (Knowles, 1989).   Second, the dialogue in the Timaeus appears to take up where that of the Republic leaves off, suggesting that Plato himself saw a continuity between the views in the two works.  It is also worth pointing out that some physicists, such as Heisenberg (1958),  have claimed that the Timaeus provided inspiration for their rejection of the materialism of Democritus in favor of the mathematical forms of Plato and the Pythagoreans (see also Brisson and Meyerstein, 1995).   For these and other reasons, a growing number of scholars have, despite the controversies, begun to return to the Timaeus with renewed philosophical interest (Vlastos, 1975; Ostenfield, 1982; Annas, 1999; Sallis, 1999; Carone, 2000; and so forth.).

b. Greek Organicism

In his introduction to Plato’s works, Cairns (1961)  points out that the Greek view, as far back as we have records, is that the world is orderly and alive.  From this perspective, the failure to appreciate Plato’s organicism is part and parcel of a failure to appreciate Greek organicism more generally. For example, whereas modern scholars view the Milesians as forerunners of modern materialism (Jeans, 1958), the Milesians held that matter is alive (Cornford, 1965; Robin, 1996).  Similarly, Anaximenes did not hold that air is the basis of all things in the same sense, or for the same reasons, that a modern materialist might hold such a view.  He views air as breath and sees air as the basis of all things because he sees the world as a living thing and therefore “wants it to breath” (Robin, 1996; Cornford, 1966). Pythagoras too, who exerted great influence on Plato, saw the world as a living breathing being (Robinson, 1968).    Cornford (1966) notes that Plato’s description in the Timaeus of his world animal as a “well rounded sphere” has been seen by some scholars as the best commentary on Parmenides’ comparison of his One Being to a perfect sphere (raising the possibility of a Parmenidean organicism).    Finally, by stressing that fire is the basis of all things, Heraclitus did not mean that fire is the material out of which all things are made.  His fire is an “ever living” fire (Burnet, 1971).  Similar points could be made about other pre-Socratic philosophers.   The Greek tendency to view the world as a living thing is rooted in the fact that the early Greek notion of nature, physis, was closer in meaning to life than to matter (Cornford, 1965).   This is why, as far back as Hesiod, procreation plays such a prominent role in Greek creation stories, as it does in the Timaeus (Section 2c.).   From this perspective, it is not surprising that Plato develops an organicist cosmology.    It would be surprising if he did not have one.

2. Plato’s Cosmogony and Cosmology

a. Creation of the World Animal

The Timaeus describes the world (kosmos) as a created living being.  The world is created by the “Demiurge  [ho demiourgos]” who follows an “eternal pattern” reminiscent of Plato’s Forms (Carone, 2000).  The materials out of which the kosmos is fashioned are already present.    The eternal patterns or Forms, the Demiurge himself, and the materials, all pre-exist the creation.  Thus, Plato’s Demiurge is not omnipotent, but is more like a craftsman, limited both by the eternal patterns and by the prior matter.  The creative act consists in putting “intelligence in soul and soul in body” in accord with the eternal patterns.  The soul in the Timaeus and Laws is understood as the principle of self-motion.

The pre-existing materials are described as “chaos.”   By “chaos” Plato does not mean the complete absence of order, but a kind of order, perhaps even a mechanical order, opposed to Reason.   This “chaotic” tendency survives the imposition of Form and is always threatening to break out and undermine the rational order of the world.   For this reason Plato’s kosmos exhibits a dynamical quality quite alien to modern thought.

The Demiurge creates a living and intelligent world because life is better than non-life and intelligent life is better than mere life.  It is “the perfect animal.”  In contrast with the Darwinian view that the emergence of life and mind are accidents of evolution, the Timaeus holds that the world is necessarily alive and intelligent.

The Timaeus identifies three different kinds of souls, the rational (eternal) soul, the spirited soul, and the plantlike soul capable of sensation but not of genuine self-motion.   The world-animal possesses the highest and most perfect kind of soul, the rational soul, but it also shares in the two lower types of soul as well.  The world may be the perfect animal, but it is not a perfect being because it possesses the lower types of soul.  The presence of these lower types of soul helps to explain the imperfection in the world.

The Timaeus holds that the world is “solitary.”   The Demiurge only creates one world, not because he is stingy, but because he can only create the best and there can only be one best world.   Since it is solitary, there is nowhere for it to go and nothing for it to perceive.   The perfect-animal has, therefore, no external limbs or sense organs.

The Demiurge gives the world the most suitable shape, that is, it is a sphere with each point on the circumference equidistant from the center.   Since it has no need of sense organs or limbs, it is perfectly smooth.  Although the pre-existing visible body is also a sphere, it turns out that a sphere is also the most suitable choice of shape for the perfect animal (Sect. 4c).  The Demiurge imposes an order on that pre-existing material sphere that makes it suitable for the introduction of a soul.    Thus, Plato does not deny that there are material or mechanical conditions for life and mind.  He only insists that these are subordinated in the world to the more basic rule by reason (McDonough, 1991).

The Demiurge makes the perfect animal in the shape of a sphere since a sphere “is the most like itself of all figures” and that makes for the most beautiful figure.  Unlike the modern view that values are a subjective coloring imposed by the human mind (Putnam, 1990), Plato’s kosmos is intrinsically beautiful and good.   Plato’s science of nature does not seek to strip things of value in order to see them “objectively”, but, rather, to describe the intrinsic values writ large in the perfect visible cosmic organism (Sect. 3a-3c).

The Demiurge puts the soul in the center of the sphere, but it “diffuses” throughout the entire sphere.   The Demiurge synchronizes the two spheres “center to center.”  Thus, Plato distinguishes between the organism’s spiritual center and its bodily center, and holds that these must be made, by the Demiurge, to correspond with each other.  This is an early version of the “correlation thesis” (Putnam, 1981), the view that there must be a correspondence between the mental and material states of the organism.   That which is produced directly by intelligence may only have a teleological explanation, while that caused by matter not controlled by intelligence may have only a physical explanation, but that which is produced by the informing of matter by intelligence admits of both a teleological and a physical explanation.   In that case, the teleological and physical “spheres” must correspond with each other.  The world-animal is One in the sense that it possesses an organic unity by virtue of its central order-imposing soul.

Since the kosmos is a perfect animal,  and since an animal has parts, the world is ”a perfect whole of perfect parts.”   The kosmos is a whole of parts because it is “the very image of that whole of which all the animals and their tribes are portions.”  The “whole” of which the kosmos is an image is called “the Form of the Intelligible Animal.”

The Form of the Intelligible Animal contains “all intelligible beings, just as this [visible] world contains all other visible creatures.”  The perfect animal must embrace all possible species of “intelligible beings.”   Thus, Plato’s world-animal is actually a whole ecosystem of interrelated animals.    It should not, however, be assumed that the cosmic animal is not also a single organism.   Although the human body is, in one sense, a single organism, it is, in another sense, a whole system of interrelated organisms (the individual cells of the body), which combine to form one more perfect organism.

The view that the Form of the intelligible animal contains all intelligible beings suggests that only animals are intelligible.   Matter as such is not intelligible.  A material thing is only intelligible because it instantiates a Form.  The Timaeus suggests that the total recipe for the instantiation of the Forms is a living organism.  The ideas that only living things are intelligible and that matter per se is unintelligible are foreign to the modern mind.   Nonetheless, Plato sees a close connection between life and intelligibility.

Since there is nothing outside the perfect animal, it exists “in itself.”  Since it exists “in itself,” it is self sufficient in the visible world.  It does depend on the Forms, but it does not depend on anything more basic in the perceptible world.   Since it moves, but is an image of the self-sufficient Forms, it moves in the most self-sufficient way, that is, it is self- moving.   Since there is nothing outside it, it can only move “within its own limits,”  that is, it can only rotate around its own axis. The circular motion of the perfect animal is the best perceptible image of the perfection and self-sameness of the eternal Forms.

Since the perfect animal is intelligent, it thinks.   Since it is self-moving, it is a self-moving thinker.   Since it is self-sufficient in the visible world, it is, in that realm, absolute spontaneity.   Plato’s characterization of the perfect animal as a “sensible God” expresses the fact that it possesses these divine qualities of self-sufficiency, self movement, and absolute spontaneity deriving from its participation in an eternal pattern.

The Timaeus presents a  complex mathematical account, involving the mixing of various types of being, in various precise proportions, of the creation of the “spherical envelope to the body of the universe,” that is, the heavens.  The more orderly movements of the heavenly bodies are better suited than earthly bodies to represent the eternal patterns, but they are not completely ordered.   In addition to the perfect circular movements of the stars, there is also the less orderly movement of the planets.  Plato distinguishes these as “the same” and “the different.”   Whereas the stars display invariable circular movements, the planets move in diverse manners, a different motion for each of the seven planets.   Thus, the movement of the stars is “undivided,” while that of  the plants is divided into separate diverse motions.   Since the former is superior, the movements of the different are subordinated to those of “the same.”  The entirely regular movement of “the same” is the perfect image of the eternal patterns, while the movement of  “the different” is a manifestation of the imperfect material body of the kosmos.   Nevertheless, since “the different” are in the heavens, they are still much more orderly than the “chaotic” movements of bodies on earth.   Although this account is plainly unbelievable, it sheds light on his concept of an organism and his views about intelligence.

To take one example, Plato invokes the dichotomy of “the same” and “the different” to explain the origins of knowledge and true belief.   Because the soul is composed of both “the same” and “the different,” she is capable of recognizing the sameness or difference in anything that “has being.”  Both knowledge and true opinion achieve truth, for “reason works with equal truth whether she is in the sphere of the diverse or of the same,” but intelligence and knowledge, the work of “the same,” are still superior to true belief, the work of “the different.”   Insofar as the heavens display the movements of “the same,” the world animal achieves intelligence and knowledge, but  insofar as “the circle of the diverse” imparts the “intimations of sense” to the soul mere true belief is achieved.    Plato is, in effect, describing a kind of celestial mechanism to explain the origins of the perfect animal’s knowledge on the one hand and true belief on the other.   His view implies that an organism must  be imperfect if it is to have true beliefs about a corporeal world and that these imperfections must be reflected in its “mechanism” of belief.

Because of their perfect circular motions, the heavens are better suited than earthly movements to measure time.    Thus, time is “the moving image of eternity.”  This temporal “image of eternity” is eternal and “moves in accord with number” while eternity itself “rests in unity.”  But time is not a representation of just any Form.  It is an image of the Form of the Intelligible Animal.   Since time is measured by the movement of the perfect bodies in the heavens, and since that movement constitutes the life of the perfect animal, time is measured by the movement of the perfect life on display in the heavens, establishing a connection between time and life carried down to Bergson (1983).

b. The Mortal Organism as Microcosm of the Macrocosm

The Demiurge creates the world-animal, but leaves the creation of mortal animals to the “created gods,” by which Plato may mean the earth (female) and the sun (male).  Since the created gods imitate the creator, mortal animals are also copies of the world-animal.   Thus, man is a microcosm of the macrocosm, a view that extends from the pre-Socratics (Robinson, 1968), through Scholastic philosophy (Wulf, 1956) and the Renaissance (Cassirer, 1979), to Leibniz (1968), Wittgenstein (1966), Whitehead (1978), and others.

Although plants and the lesser animals are briefly discussed in the Timaeus, the only mortal organism described in detail is man.  Since imperfections are introduced at each stage of copying, man is less perfect than the cosmic-animal, the lesser animals are less perfect than man, and plants are less perfect than the lesser animals.  This yields a hierarchy of organisms, a “great chain of being,” arranged from the most perfect world-animal at the top to the least perfect organisms at the bottom (Lovejoy, 1964).

Since an ordinary organism is a microcosm of the macrocosm, the structure of a mortal organism parallels that of the macrocosm.  Since the structure of the macrocosm is the structure of the heavens (broadly construed to include the earth at the center of the heavenly spheres), one need not rely on empirical studies of ordinary biological organisms.  Since the Timaeus holds that the archetype of an organism is “writ large” in the heavens, the science of astronomy is the primary guide to the understanding of living things. In this respect, our modern view owes more to Aristotle, who accorded greater dignity to the empirical study of ordinary living things (Hamilton, 1964, p. 32).

Since the macrocosm is a sphere with the airy parts at the periphery and the earth at the center, ordinary organisms also have a spherical structure with the airy parts at the periphery and the heavier elements at the center.   Since an ordinary organism is less perfect than the world animal, its spherical shape is distorted.   Although there are three kinds of souls, these are housed in separate bodily spheres.   The rational, or immortal, soul is located in the sphere of the head.  The two mortal souls are encased in the sphere of the thorax and the sphere of the abdomen.   The division of the mortal soul into two parts is compared with the division of a household into the male and female “quarters.”

The head contains the first principle of life.  The soul is united with the body at its center.  Since Plato uses “marrow” as a general term for the material at the center of a seed, the head contains the brain “marrow” suited to house the most divine soul.  There are other kinds of “marrows” at the centers of the chest and abdomen.    The sphere is the natural shape for an animal because the principle of generation takes the same form as a seed, and most seeds are spherical.  The head is a “seed” that gives birth to immortal thoughts.  The thorax and abdomen are “seeds” that give birth to their own appropriate motions.

The motions in the various organic systems imitate the circular motions of the heavens.   Respiration is compared to “the rotation of a wheel.”    Since there can be no vacuum, air taken in at one part forces the air already there to move out of its place, which forces the air further down to move, and so on.  Plato gives a similar account of the circulatory system.  The blood is compelled to move by the action of the heart in the center of the chest.  “[T]he particles of the blood … which are contained within the frame of the animal as in a sort of heaven, are compelled to imitate the motion of the universe.”    The blood circulates around the central heart just as the stars circulate around the central earth.   Similar accounts are given of ingestion and evacuation.   The action of the lungs, heart, and so forth, constitutes the bodily mechanism that implements the organic telos.    In the Phaedo and Laws, Plato compares the Earth, the “true mother of us all,” to an organism with its own circulatory systems of subterranean rivers of water and lava.  The organic model of the heavens is the template for an organic model of the geological structure of the earth.

Since the perfect animal has no limbs or sense organs, “the other six [the non-circular] motions were taken away from him.”  Since there is no eternal pattern for these chaotic motions associated with animal life, they are treated as unintelligible.  There is, for Plato, no science of chaos.  His remarks are consistent with the view that there can be a mechanics of the non-circular bodily motions, but since such a mechanics cannot give the all- important reason for the motion it so does not qualify as a science in Plato’s sense.

Since the rise of the mechanistic world view in the 18th century, it has been impossible for modern thinkers to take Plato’s cosmology seriously.  It cannot, however, be denied that it is a breathtaking vision.   If nothing else, it is a startling reminder how differently ancient thinkers viewed the universe.   According to the Timaeus, we on earth live at the center of one unique perfect cosmic organism, in whose image we have been created, and whose nature and destiny has been ordained by imperceptible transcendent forces from eternity.  When we look up at the night sky, we are not seeing mere physical bodies moving in accord with blind mechanical laws, but, rather, are, quite literally, seeing the radiant airy periphery of that single perfect cosmic life, the image of our own (better) selves, from which we draw our being, our guidance, and our destiny.

Finally, Plato is, in the Timaeus, fashioning important components of our concept of an organism, a concept which survives even when his specific quaint theories, do not.  For example, biologists have noted that animals, especially those, like Plato’s perfect animal, that have no need of external sense organs or limbs, tend towards a spherical shape organized around a center (Buchsbaum, 1957).  Indeed, central state materialism, the modern view that the intelligence is causally traceable to the neural center, is, arguably, a conceptual descendent of Plato’s notion of an organism organized around a center.

c. Creation as Procreation

 

Whereas in his earlier dialogues Plato had distinguished Forms and perceptible objects, the latter copies of the former,  the Timaeus announces the need to posit yet another kind of being, “the Receptacle,” or “nurse of all generation.”  The Receptacle is like the Forms insofar as it is a “universal nature” and is always “the same,” but it must be “formless” so that it can “take every variety of form.”   The Receptacle is likened to “the mother” of all generation, while “the source or spring” of generation, the Demiurge, is likened to the father.   In the Timaeus, the creation of the world is not a purely intellectual act, but, following the sexual motif in pre-Socratic cosmogony, it is modeled on sexual generation.

Plato’s argument for positing the Receptacle is that since visible objects do not exist in themselves, and since they do not exist in the Forms, they must exist “in another,” and the Receptacle is this “other” in which visible objects exist, that is, the argument for positing the Receptacle is premised on the ontologically  dependent status of visible objects.

Since the perfect motion is circular, generation too moves in a circle.  This is true of the generation of the basic elements, earth, air, fire, and water, out of each other, but it is also true of animal generation.  Since the parents of a certain type only generate offspring of the same type, the cycle of procreation always returns, in a circular movement, to the same point from which it started    It is only in creating a copy of themselves, which then go on to do that same, that mortal creatures partake of the eternal (Essentially the same picture is found in Plato’s Symposium and in Aristotle’s Generation of Animals).  Since the sexual act presupposes the prior existence of the male and female principles, the procreation model also explains why Plato’s Demiurge does not create from nothing.

Plato identifies the Receptacle with space, but also suggests that the basic matters, such as fire, are part of its nature, so it cannot be mere space.   Although Plato admits that it somehow “partakes of the intelligible,” he also states that it “is hardly real” and that we only behold it “as in a dream.”   Despite the importance of this view in the Timaeus, Plato is clearly puzzled, and concludes that the Receptacle is only apprehended by a kind of “spurious reason.”   Given his comparison of the receptacle to the female principle, he may think that visible objects are dependent on “another” in something like the sense in which a foetus is dependent on the mother’s womb.  On the other hand, Plato admits that these are murky waters and it is doubtful that the sexual imagery can be taken literally.

d. Emergence of Kosmos from Chaos

The Western intellectual tradition begins, arguably, with the cosmogony in Hesiod’s Theogony, according to which the world emerges from chaos.  A similar story is found in Plato’s creation story in the Timaeus, where, in the beginning, everything is in “disorder” and any “proportion” between things is accidental.   None of the kinds, such as fire, water, and so forth, exist.  These had to be “first set in order” by God, who then, out of them, creates the cosmic animal.   Since the root meaning of the Greek “kosmos” is orderly arrangement, the Timaeus presents a classic picture of the emergence of order out of chaos.

The doctrine of emergent evolution, associated with Bergson (1983), Alexander (1920), and Morgan (1923), is the view that the laws of nature evolve over time (Nagel, 1979).   Since, in the Timaeus, the laws of nature are not fixed by the conditions in the primordial “chaos,” but only arise, under the supervision of the Demiurge, in a temporal process, Plato’s cosmology appears to anticipate these later views.  Mourelatos (1986) argues that emergentism is present in the later pre-Socratic philosophers.  Although emergentism has been out of fashion for some time, it has recently been enjoying a revival (See Kim, Beckermann, and Flores, 1992; McDonough, 2002; Clayton and Davies, 2006, and so forth).

3. Relevance to Plato’s Philosophy

a. Relevance to Plato’s Aesthetics

Since reason dictates that the best creation is the perfect animal, the living kosmos is the most beautiful created thing.   Since the perfect animal is a combination of soul and body, these must be combined in the right proportion.   The correct proportion of these constitutes the organic unity of the organism.   Thus, the beauty of an organism consists in its organic unity.   Since other mortal organisms are microcosms of the macrocosm, the standard of beauty for a mortal organism is set by the beauty of the kosmos.   The beauty of a human being is, in effect, modeled on the beauty of a world.

There is a link between beauty and pleasure, but pleasure is derivative.  Since beauty is a matter of  rational proportion, a rational person naturally finds the sight of beauty pleasurable.   Thus, a rational person finds a well proportioned organism beautiful, where the relevant proportions include not merely physical proportions but the most basic proportion between body and soul.   Finally, since an organism has an organic unity, rationality, beauty, health and virtue can only occur together.    Thus, Plato’s aesthetics shades into his ethics, his view of medicine, and his conception of philosophy itself.

b. Relevance to Plato’s Ethics

Perhaps the most basic objection to Plato’s ethics is the charge that his view that the Forms are patterns for conduct is empty of content.   What can it mean for a changeable, corporeal, mortal, living creature to imitate a non-living immaterial, eternal, unchanging, abstract object?   Plato’s organicist cosmology addresses this gap in his ethical theory.

Since the kosmos is copied from the Form of the Intelligible Animal, and since man is a microcosm of the macrocosm, there is a kinship between the rational part of man and the cosmic life on display in the heavens.   There is a close link, foreign to the modern mind, between ethics and astronomy (Carone, 2000).  This explains why, in the Theaetetus, Socrates states that the philosopher spends their time “searching the heavens.”

Specifically, the ethical individual must strive to imitate the self-sufficiency of the kosmos.  Since the most fundamental dimension of self-sufficiency is self-movement, the ethical individual must strive to be self-moving (like the heavenly bodies).  Since the eternal soul is the rational soul, not the animal or vegetable soul, the ethical individual aims at the life of self-moving rational contemplation.  Since the highest form of the rational life is the life of philosophy, the ethical life coincides with the life of philosophy.

As self-moving, the ethical individual is not moved by external forces, but by the “laws of destiny.”  One must not interpret this in a modern sense.  Plato’s ethical individual is not a cosmic rebel.   The ethical individual does not have their own individualistic destiny.  Since a mortal living being is a microcosm of the macrocosm, it shares in the single law of destiny of the kosmos.  Socrates had earlier stated the analogous view in the Meno that “all nature is akin.”  There is a harmony between man’s law of destiny and that of the kosmos.   Because of their corrupt bodily nature, human beings have fallen away from their cosmic destiny.   Thus, the fundamental ethical imperative is that human beings must strive to reunite with the universal cosmic life from which they have fallen away, the archetype of which is displayed in the heavens.   The ethical law for man is but a special case of the universal law of destiny that applies to all life in the universe.

The bad life is the unbalanced life.   A life is unbalanced when it falls short of the ideal organic unity.   Thus, evil is a kind of disease of the soul.   Since the body is the inferior partner in the union of soul and body, evil results from the undue influence of the body on the soul  Since body and soul are part of an organic unity, and since the soul does not move without the body and vice versa, the diseases of the soul are diseases of the body and vice versa.  Due regard must be given to the bodily needs, but since the soul is the superior partner in that union, the proper proportion is achieved when the rational soul rules the body.   The recipe for a good life is the same as the recipe for a healthy organism.   Thus, the ethics of the Timaeus shades into an account of health and medicine (Sect. 3c).   Since the ethical individual is the philosopher, the account of all of these shades in to account of the philosopher as well.   The ethical individual, the healthy individual, the beautiful individual, and the philosopher are one and the same.

The cosmology of the Timaeus may also serve to counterbalance the elitism in Plato’s earlier ethical views.  Whereas, in Plato’s middle period dialogues, it is implied that goodness and wisdom are only possible for the best human beings (philosophers), the Timaeus suggests the more egalitarian view that since human life is a microcosm of the macrocosm, ethical salvation is possible for all human beings (Carone, 2000).

Plato’s organicism also suggests a more optimistic view of ethical life than is associated with orthodox Platonism.  Whereas, in Plato’s middle period dialogues, the ethical person is represented to be at the mercy of an evil world, and unlikely to be rewarded for their good efforts, the Timaeus posits a “cosmic mechanism” in which virtue is its own reward (Carone, 2000).   Although Socrates may be victimized by unjust men, the ultimate justice is meted out, not in the human law courts, but in the single universal cosmic life.

On the more negative side, Plato’s celestial organicism does commit him to a kind of astrology:  The Demiurge “assigned to each soul a star, and having there placed them as in a chariot, he … declared to them the laws of destiny.”  Taken literally, this opens Plato to easy caricature, but taken symbolically, as it may well be intended, it is a return to the Pythagorean idea that ethical salvation is achieved, not by setting oneself up in individual opposition to the world, but by reuniting with the cosmic rhythm from which one has fallen away (Allen, 1966).   Although this may look more like a cult or religion to modern thinkers, it is worth noting that it does anticipate the criticism of  the human-centered vision of ethics by the modern “deep ecology” movement (Naess, 1990).

c. Relevance to Plato’s Political Philosophy

Since Plato sees an analogy between the polis and the kosmos (Carone, 2000), and since the kosmos is a living organism, Plato’s concept of organism illuminates his account of the polis.   Just as the kosmos is a combination of Reason (Nous) and Necessity (chaos), so too is the polis.   Just as Demiurge brings the kosmos into being by making the primordial chaos submit to Reason, so too, the Statesman brings the polis into being by making the chaos of human life submit to reason.  Carone (2000) suggests that politics, for Plato, is itself is a synthesis of Reason and Necessity.   It is, in this connection, significant, that in Greek, the word “Demiurge” can mean magistrate (Carone, 2000). See Plato’s Political Philosophy.

d. Relevance to Plato’s Account of Health and Medicine

Since an organism is an organic whole, beauty, virtue, wisdom, and health must occur together.   Just as Plato’s organicism issues in an aesthetics and an ethics, it also issues in an account of medicine.   Health is a state of orderly bodily motions induced by the soul, while disease is a state of disorder induced by the chaos of the body.   The diseases of the soul, such as sexual intemperance, are caused by the undue influence of the body on the soul, with the consequence that a person who is foolish is not so voluntarily.

Since an organism is an organic whole, one does not treat the heart in order to cure the person.  One treats the whole person in order to cure the heart.   Since the union of body and soul is fundamental, health requires the correct proportion between them.  Since the enemy of health is the chaos of the body, health is achieved by imitating the rational pattern of the heavens.   Since the heavens are self-moving, that motion is the best which is self-produced.   Thus, a self-imposed “regimen” of rational discipline and gymnastic, including the arts and all philosophy, is the optimal way to manage disease.

Unfortunately, most professors of medicine fail to see that disease is a natural part of life.  Although mortal organisms live within limits, professors of medicine are committed to the impossible task of contravening these limits by external force, medications, surgery, and so forth.  By ignoring an organism’s inherent limits, they fail to respect the inner laws of harmony and proportion in nature.   Just as self-movement is, in general, good, movement caused by some external agency is, in general, bad.   Since an organism is a self-moving rational ordering with its own inherent limits, the best course is to identify the unhealthy habits that have led to the malady and institute a “regimen” to restore the organism to its natural cycles.   In a concession to common sense, however, Plato does allow that intervention by external force may be permissible when the disease is “very dangerous.”

Plato’s view of medicine may seem quaint, but since, on his view, beauty, health, virtue, and wisdom are aspects of (or, perhaps, flow from) a fundamental condition of organic unity, his views on medicine shed light on his aesthetics, ethics, and his conception of philosophy.   Health is, in various Platonic dialogues (Republic 444c-d, Laws, 733e, and so forth.), associated with the philosophical and virtuous life.  The fact that the Timaeus’ recipe for health includes a strong dose of “all philosophy” betokens Plato’s view that health, like wisdom and virtue, are specific states of an organism that derive, and can only derive, from a certain central unifying power of the philosophic soul.

e. Relevance to Plato’s Theory of Forms

Although it may seem that Plato’s organicism is irrelevant to his theory of Forms, or even that it is incompatible with it, it is arguable that it supplements and strengthens the theory of Forms.  The three main tenets of the theory of Forms are that (1) the world of Forms is separate from the world of perceptible objects (the two-world view), (2)  perceptible objects are images or copies of the Forms, and (3)  perceptible objects are unreal or “less real” than the Forms.

With regard to the first thesis, there appears to be a tension between Plato’s organicism and the two-world view.  f the kosmos is perfect and beautiful, not infer that the Forms are not separate from the kosmos but are present in it?   On the other hand, since Aristotle says in the Metaphysics that Plato never abandoned the two-world theory, it is prudent to leave the first thesis unchanged.  Even if Plato’s organicism undercuts some of the original motivations for the two-world view, it does not require its rejection (Sect. 4b).

Although Plato’s organicism does not require a rejection of the second thesis, the view that perceptible objects are images of the Forms, it puts it in a different light. Rather, it suggests that perceptible objects are not images of Forms in the sense in which a photograph is an image of a man, but in something like the sense in which a child is an image of its parents (Sect. 2c).   From this perspective, the orthodox reading of Plato relies on a one-sided view of the image-model and thereby makes Plato’s theory of Forms appear to denigrate the perceptible world more than it really must do (Patterson, 1985).

Plato’s organicism also puts the third thesis, the view that perceptible objects are less real than the Forms, in a new light.   Since most philosophers see the picture of degrees of reality as absurd, Plato’s views are open to easy ridicule.   However, Plato’s organicism suggests that this objection is based on a confusion.     On this view, when Plato states or implies that some items are less real than others, he is arranging them in a hierarchy based on to the degree in which they measure up to a certain ideal of organic unity.  On this scale, a man has more “being” than a tomato because a man has a higher degree of organic unity than a tomato.    That has nothing to do with the absurd view that tomatoes do not exist or that they only exist to a lesser degree.   The view that Plato is committed to these absurd ideas derives from an equivocation of Plato’s notion of “being” (roughly organic unity) with the notion of existence denoted by the existential quantifier.

Rather than being either irrelevant to Plato’s philosophy or incompatible with it, Plato’s organicism provides new interpretations of certain concepts in those theories.   Indeed, it suggests that some of the standard criticisms of Plato’s views are based on equivocations.

4. Influence of Plato’s Cosmology

a. Transition to Aristotle’s Organicism

Although Plato’s organicism does seem to be consistent with a theory of Forms, it does not come without a price for that theory.  The theory of Forms had been posited to act as causes, as standards, and as objects of knowledge (Prior, 1985), and Plato’s organicism does undermine some of the original motivations for the theory of Forms.  For example, Plato’s argument that the Forms are needed as standards requires a depreciation of the perceptible world. If living organisms are not merely an image of perfection and beauty, but are themselves perfect and beautiful, then these can act as intelligible standards and there is no special need to posit another separate world of superior intelligible existence. Similar arguments can be extended to the view that Forms are needed as causes and as objects of knowledge.  If one enriches the perceptible world by populating it with intelligible entities, that is, living organisms possessed of their own internal idea, there is no need to look for intelligible standards, causes, or objects of knowledge, in a separate Platonic realm.  In that case, positing a world of separate Forms is an unnecessary metaphysical hypothesis.  This is precisely the direction taken by Aristotle.

Aristotle follows Plato in speaking of form and matter, but, unlike Plato, he does not separate the form from the perceptible objects. Aristotle holds that what is real are substances, roughly, individual packages of formed matter. However, not just any perceptible entity is a substance.  In the Metaphysics (1032a15-20), Aristotle states that “animals and plants and things of that kind” are substances “if anything is.”   On this view, part of the importance of the Timaeus is that it is intermediary between Plato’s orthodox theory of Forms and Aristotle’s theory substance (Johansen, 2004), a point which is lost if the Timaeus is dismissed as a mere literary work with no philosophical significance.  See Sellars (1967), Furth (1987), and McDonough (2000) for further discussions of Aristotle’s organicism.

b. Importance for Contemporary Philosophy

 

Since Plato’s organicist cosmology includes many plainly unbelievable views (Russell, 1945), the question arises why modern philosophers should take it seriously. Several important points of importance for contemporary philosophy have emerged.  First, Plato’s organicist cosmology is relevant to the interpretation of his theory of Forms by providing new interpretations of key terms in that pivotal theory, and it may even provide an escape from some of the standard objections of that theory (Sect. 4b). Second, Plato’s organicism is intimately linked to his notion of man as the microcosm, a view which appears again in Whitehead’s process philosophy, Wittgenstein’s Tractatus, and others. Third, Plato’s organicism illuminates his ethical views (Sect. 3.2). Fourth, since Plato conceives of the polis on analogy with an organism, it sheds light on his political philosophy (Sect. 3d). Fifth, Plato’s organicism illuminates his account of health and medicine (Sect. 3d), which, in turn, is the classical inspiration for modern holistic views of health and medicine. Sixth, the concept of an organism as, roughly, a sphere organized around a causal center, of which modern “central state materialism is a conceptual descendent,  traces, arguably, to Plato’s Timaeus (Sect. 2b).  Seventh, the Timaeus deserves to be recognized for its contribution to the history of emergentism, which has again become topical in the philosophy of mind (Sect. 2d). Eighth, Aristotle’s theory of substance bears certain conceptual and historical connections to Plato’s organicism (Sect. 4b).  To the degree that these views are important to contemporary philosophy, and history of philosophy, Plato’s organicism is important as well.

5. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

  • Aristotle. 1951.  Metaphysics. Trans. W.D. Ross. The Basic Works of Aristotle. Ed.Richard McKeon.  Pp. 689-933.
  • Aristotle.  1953. Generation of Animals. A.L. Peck, Trans. Cambridge, Mass: Harvard University Press & London, England: William Heinemann, Ltd.
  • Plato. 1968. Republic. Trans.,  Alan Bloom. New York and London: Basic Books.
  • Plato. 1969. Apology. Hugh Tredennick, Trans. Collected Dialogues of Plato.  E. Hamilton and H. Cairns, Ed.  Princeton:  Princeton University Press. Pp.3-26.
  • Plato.  1969.  Phaedo. Hugh Tredennick, Trans.  Collected Dialogues of Plato.  E. Hamilton and H. Cairns, Ed.  Princeton:  Princeton University Press. Pp. 40-98.
  • Plato.  1969.  Gorgias.  W.D. Woodhead, Trans.  Collected Dialogues of Plato.  E.  Hamilton and H. Cairns, Ed.  Princeton:  Princeton University Press. Pp. 229-307.
  • Plato. 1969.   Protagoras.   W.K.C. Guthrie, Trans.  Collected Dialogues of Plato.  E.  Hamilton and H. Cairns, Ed.  Princeton:  Princeton University Press. Pp. 308-352.
  • Plato.  1969.  Theaetetus.  F.M. Cornford, Trans. Collected Dialogues of Plato.  E.  Hamilton and H. Cairns, Ed.  Princeton:  Princeton University Press. Pp. 957-1017.
  • Plato.  1969.  Sophist.  F.M. Cornford, Trans.  Collected Dialogues of Plato.  E. Hamilton and H. Cairns, Ed.  Princeton:  Princeton University Press. Pp. 845-919.
  • Plato.  1969.  Philebus.   R. Hackforth, Trans.  Collected Dialogues of Plato.  E.  Hamilton and H. Cairns, Ed.  Princeton:  Princeton University Press. Pp. 1086-1150.
  • Plato.   1969.   Timaeus.   Benjamin Jowett, Trans.  Collected Dialogues of Plato.  E. Hamilton and H. Cairns, Ed.  Princeton:  Princeton University Press. Pp. 1151-1211.
  • Plato.  1969.  Laws.  A.E. Taylor, Trans.  Collected Dialogues of Plato.  E. Hamilton and H. Cairns, Ed.  Princeton:  Princeton University Press. Pp. 1225-1516.
  • Plato.  1997.  Symposium.  Alexander Nehamas and Paul Woodruff, Trans.  Plato: Complete Works.  John Cooper, Ed.  Indianapolis/Cambridge: Hackett. Pp. 457-505.

b. Secondary Sources

  • Allen, Reginald E.  1966.  Introduction to Greek Philosophy: Thales to Aristotle.  Ed. Reginald E. Allen.  New York: The Free Press.  Pp. 1-23.
  • Alexander, S. I.  1920.  Space, Time, and Deity, 2 vols. London: Macmillan.
  • Bergson, Henri.  1983.  Creative Evolution.  A. Mitchell, Trans.  Lanham, MD: University Press of America.
  • Brandwood, Leonard.  1992.  “Stylometry and Chronology.”  The Cambridge Companion to Plato.  Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.  Pp. 90-120.
  • Brisson,  Luc, and Meyerstein, F. Walter.    1995.  Inventing the Universe: Plato’s Timaeus, the Big Bang, and the Problem of Scientific Knowledge. Albany: State University of New York Press.
  • Buchsbaum, Ralph.  1957.  Animals Without Backbones. Vol. I.  Middlesex, England: Penguin Books.
  • Burnet, John.  1971.  Early Greek Philosophy.   London: Adam and Charles Black.
  • Cairns, Huntington.  1961.  Introduction to The Collected Dialogues of Plato.  Princeton: Princeton University Press. Pp. xiii-xxv.
  • Cassirer, Ernst.  1979.  The Individual and the Cosmos in Renaissance Philosophy.  Trans. Mario Domandi.  Philadelphia: University of Pennsylvania Press.
  • Cornford.  F.M.  1965.   From Religion to Philosophy:  A Study in the Origins of Western Speculation.  New York: Harper and Row.
  • Cornford.  F.M.  1966.  Plato’s Cosmology:  The Timaeus of Plato.  The Liberal Arts Press.
  • Cornford.  F.M.  1997.  Introduction to Plato:  Timaeus.  Indianapolis: Hackett.  Pp. ix-xv.
  • Carone, Gabriela Roxana.  2005.  Plato’s Cosmology and its Ethical Dimensions.  Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Clayton, Philip, and Davies, Paul., Ed’s.  2006.   The Re-Emergence of Emergence: The Emergentist Hypothesis from Science to Religion.  Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Furth, Montgomery.  1988.  Substance, Form, and Psyche: An Aristotelian Metaphysics.  Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Hamilton, Edith.  1964.  The Greek Way.  New York: The W.W. Norton Co.
  • Heisenberg, Werner.  1958.  Physics and Philosophy.   London: George Allen and Unwin.
  • Johansen, Thomas Kjeller.  2004.  Plato’s Natural Philosophy: A Study of the Timaeus-Critias.   Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Kim,  Jaegwon, Beckermann, Angsar, and Flores, Hans, Ed’s.  1992.  Emergence or Reduction? Berlin: De Gruyter.
  • Knowles, David.  1989.  Evolution of Medieval Thought.  United Kingdom: Longman.
  • Kraut, Richard.  1992.  “Introduction to the Study of Plato.”   The Cambridge Companion to Plato.  Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.  Pp. 1-50.
  • Leibniz, G.W.  1968.  “Principles of Nature and Grace.”  Leibniz: Philosophical Writings.  Trans, Mary Morris.  New York: Dutton & London: Dent.  Pp. 21-31.
  • Lovejoy, A.O.  1964.  The Great Chain of Being.  Cambridge: Harvard University Press.
  • McDonough, Richard.  1991. “Plato’s not to Blame for Cognitive Science.”  Ancient Philosophy. Vol. 11.  1991.  Pp. 301-314.
  • McDonough, Richard.  2000.  “Aristotle’s Critique of Functionalist Theories of  Mind.”  Idealistic Studies.  Vol. 30.  No. 3.  pp. 209-232.
  • McDonough, Richard.  2002.  “Emergence and Creativity: Five Degrees of Freedom” (including a discussion with the editor).  In Creativity, Cognition and Knowledge.  Terry Dartnall, Ed.  London:  Praeger.  Pp. 283-320.
  • Meinwald, Constance C.  1992.  “Goodbye to the Third Man.”  The Cambridge Companion to Plato.  Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.  Pp. 365-396.
  • Morgan, Lloyd.  1923.  Emergent Evolution. London: Williams and Norgate, 1923.
  • Mourelatos,  A.  1986.  “Quality, Structure, and Emergence in Later Pre-Socratic Philosophy.”  Proceedings of the Boston Colloquium in Ancient Philosophy.  2,  Pp. 127-194.
  • Muirhead, John H.  1931.  The Platonic Tradition in Anglo-Saxon Philosophy.  New York: The Macmillan Company & London: George Allen & Unwin.
  • Naess, Arne.  1990.  Ecology, Community, Lifestyle: Outelines of an Ecosophy.  Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Nagel, Ernst.  1979.  The Structure of Science.  Indianapolis: Hackett.
  • Patterson, Richard.  1985.  Image and Reality in Plato’s Metaphysics.  Indianapolis: Hackett.
  • Prior, William J.  1985.  The Unity and Development of Plato’s Metaphysics.  LaSalle, Illinois: Open Court.
  • Putnam, Hilary. 1981.  Reason, Truth, and History.  Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Putnam, Hilary.  1990.  Realism with a Human Face.  Cambridge: Harvard University Press.
  • Robin, Leon.  1996.  Greek Thought and the Origins of the Scientific Spirit.  London and New York: Routledge.
  • Robinson, John Mansley.  1968.  An Introduction to Early Greek Philosophy.  Houghton Mifflin College Division.
  • Russell, Bertrand.  1945.  A History of Western Philosophy.  New York: Simon & Schuster.
  • Sallis, John.   1999.  Chorology:  On Beginning in Plato’s Timaeus.  Indianapolis: Indiana University Press.
  • Sellars, Wilfrid.  1967.  “Raw Materials, Subjects, and Substrata.”   Philosophical Perspectives.   Springfield, Illinois:  Charles C. Thomas, Publisher.  Pp. 137-152.
  • Taylor, A.E.  1928.  A Commentary on Plato’s Timaeus.  Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Vlastos, Gregory. 1975.  Plato’s Universe.  Seattle: University of Washington Press.
  • Whitehead, A. N.  1978.  Process and Reality (Corrected Edition).   New York: Macmillan and London: Collier Macmillan.
  • Wittgenstein, Ludwig.  1966.  Tractatus-logico-philosophicus.  Trans, D F. Pears and B. F. McGuiness.  New York: Routledge and Kegan Paul Ltd.
  • Wulf, Maurice De.  1956.  Scholastic Philosophy.   New York: Dover Publications.

Author Information

Richard McDonough
rmm249@cornell.edu
Arium Academy and James Cook University
Singapore