Persistence in Time
No person ever steps into the same river twice—or so goes the Heraclitean maxim. Obscure as it is, the maxim is often taken to express two ideas. The first is that everything always changes, and nothing remains perfectly similar to how it was just one instant before. The second is that nothing survives this constant flux of change. Where there appears to be a single river, a single person or, more generally, a single thing, there in fact is a series of different instantaneous objects succeeding one another. No person ever steps into the same river twice, for it is not the same river, and not the same person.
Is the Heraclitean maxim correct? Is it true that nothing survives change, and that nothing persists through time? These ancient questions are still at the center of contemporary metaphysics. This article surveys the main contemporary theories of persistence through time, such as three-dimensionalism, four-dimensionalism and the stage view (§ 1), and reviews the main objections proposed against them (§ 2, 3, 4).
Theories of persistence are an integral part of the more general field of the metaphysics of time. Familiarity with other debates in the metaphysics of time, universals, and mereology is here presupposed and can be acquired by studying the articles ‘Time’, ‘Universals’, ‘Properties’, and ‘Material Constitution’ in this encyclopedia.
Table of Contents
- Theories of Persistence
- Arguments against Endurantism
- Arguments against Perdurantism
- Arguments against Stage View
- What Is Not Covered in this Article
- References and Further Reading
1. Theories of Persistence
This chapter presents contemporary theories of persistence from their most basic (§ 1a) to their most advanced forms (§ 1b and § 1c). It then discusses some ways of making sense of temporal parts (§ 1d), the relation between theories of persistence and theories of time (§ 1e), and the topic of the persistence of events (§ 1f).
a. The Basics
While the Heraclitean maxim denies that anything survives change and persists through time, we normally assume that some things do survive change and do persist through time. This bottle of sparkling water, for example, was here 5 minutes ago, and still is, despite its being now half empty. This notepad, for another example, will still exist tonight, even if I will have torn off some of its pages. In other words, we normally assume some things to persist through time. But before wondering whether our assumptions are right or wrong, we should wonder: what is it for something to persist? Here is an influential definition, first introduced by David Lewis (1986, 202):
| Persistence | Something persists through time if and only if it exists at various times. |
So, the bottle persists through time, if it does at all, because it exists at various times—such as now as well as five minutes ago, and the notepad persists through time because it exists at various times—such as now as well as later tonight.
Lewis’ definition makes use of the notion of existence at a time. The notion is technical, but its intended meaning should be clear enough. The following intuitive gloss might help clarify it. Something exists at, and only at, those times at which it is, in some sense, present, or to be found. So, Socrates existed in 400 B.C.E. but not in 1905, while I exist in 2019, at all instants that make up 2019, but at no time before the date of my birth (on temporal existence: Sider 2001: 58-59).
Persistence through time is sometimes also alternatively called ‘diachronic identity’—literally, ‘identity across time’. The reason for this name is simple enough. If this notepad exists now and will also exist afterwards, then there is a sense in which the notepad which exists now and the notepad that will exist later on are the same and identical. In which sense are they identical? What is the kind of identity here involved?
It is useful to introduce here a fundamental distinction between numerical and qualitative identity. On the one hand, numerical identity is the binary relation that anything bears to itself, and to itself alone (Noonan and Curtis 2018). For example, I, like everything else, am numerically identical to myself and to nothing else. Superman, for another example, is numerically identical to Clark Kent and Augustus is numerically identical with the first Roman emperor. This relation is called ‘numerical identity’, for it is related in an important way with the number of entities that exist. If superman is numerically identical to Clark Kent, then they are one entity, and not two. And if superman is numerically different from batman, then they are two entities, and not one. On the other hand, qualitative identity is nothing else than perfect similarity (Noonan and Curtis 2018). If two water molecules could have exactly the same mass, electrical charge, spatial configuration, and so on, so as to be perfectly similar, then they would be qualitatively identical. (It is controversial whether two entities can ever be perfectly similar—more on this later. Still, it is not difficult to find cases of perfect similarity. For example, an entity at a time is perfectly similar to itself at the same time.)
Having distinguished qualitative and numerical identity, what is, again, the sense of identity that is involved in diachronic identity? It is numerical identity. For recall: the question was whether, say, a river is a single—thus one—entity existing at different times, or rather a series of—thus many—instantaneous entities existing one after another.
Here is a second outstanding question that concerns persistence. Suppose that the Heraclitean maxim is wrong, and things persist through time. Do all things that persist through time persist in the same way? Or are there different ways of persisting through time? The consensus is that there are in fact several ways of persisting through time. In order to appreciate this fact, it is useful to contrast two kinds of entities that are supposed to persist, in one sense or another, through time: events and material objects. On the one hand, consider events. An event is here taken to be anything that is said to occur, happen, or take place (Cresswell 1986, Hacker 1982). Examples include a football match, a war, the spinning of a sphere, the collision of two electrons, the life of a person. Changes, processes, and prolonged states, if any, are notable examples of events. On the other hand, a material object can be thought of as the subject of those events, such as the football players, the soldiers, the sphere, the electrons and the person who lives. (For more on events see: What is an Event?)
Both material objects and events, or at least some of them, seem to persist through time. We have already discussed some examples involving objects, and it is equally easy to find examples of persisting events—basically, any temporally extended event would do. However, even if both objects and events seem to persist through time, they seem to do that in two different ways. An event persists through time by having different parts at different times. For example, a football match has two halves. These halves are parts of the match. But clearly enough they are not spatial parts of the match: they are not spread across different places, but across different times. That is why such parts are called ‘temporal parts’. The way of persisting of an event, by having different temporal parts at different times, is called ‘perdurance’ (Lewis 1986: 202).
| Perdurance | Something perdures if and only if it persists by having different temporal parts at different times. |
Throughout this article, ‘part’ means ‘proper part’, unless otherwise specified.
On the other hand, an object seems to persist in a different way. If an object persists through time, what is present of an object at different times is not a part of it, but rather the object itself, in its wholeness or entirety. This way of persisting, whereby something persists by being wholly present at different times, is called ‘endurance’ (Lewis 1986: 202). (‘Wholly present’ here clearly contrasts with the ‘partial’ presence of an event at different times—more on this later.)
| Endurance | Something endures if and only if it persists by being wholly present at different times. |
That being said, the contemporary debate on persistence focuses on material objects. In which way do they persist, if at all? A first theory, which takes the intuitions presented so far at face value, says that objects do indeed persist by being wholly present at different times, and so endure. (Endurantists include Baker (1997, 2000); Burke (1992, 1994); Chisholm (1976); Doepke (1982); Gallois (1998); Geach (1972a); Haslanger (1989); Hinchliff (1996); Johnston (1987); Lombard (1994); Lowe (1987, 1988, 1995); Mellor (1981, 1998); Merricks (1994, 1995); Oderberg (1993); Rea (1995, 1997, 1998); Simons (1987); Thomson (1983, 1998); van Inwagen (1981, 1990a, 1990b); Wiggins (1968, 1980); Zimmerman (1996).)
| Endurantism | Ordinary material objects persist by being wholly present at different times; they are three-dimensional entities. |
Endurantism is usually taken to be closer to common sense and favored by our intuitions. However, as we see later, endurantism does not come without problems. Due to those problems, and inspired by the spatiotemporal worldview suggested by modern physics, contemporary philosophers have also taken seriously the idea that objects are four-dimensional entities spread out both in space and time, and which divide into parts just like their spatiotemporal location does, and thus persist through time by having different temporal parts at different times, just like events do. This view is called perdurantism. (Perdurantists include Armstrong (1980); Balashov (2000); Broad (1923); Carnap (1967); Goodman (1951); Hawley (1999); Heller (1984, 1990); Le Poidevin (1991); Lewis (1986, 1988); McTaggart (1921, 1927); Quine (1953, 1960, 1970, 1981); Russell (1914, 1927); Smart (1972, 1963); Whitehead (1920).)
| Perdurantism | Ordinary material objects persist by having different temporal parts at different times; they are four-dimensional entities. |
Perdurantism is also known as ‘four-dimensionalism’—for perdurantism has it that objects are extended in four dimensions (this contrasts with endurantism, according to which objects are extended at most in the three spatial dimensions, and hence is also called ‘three-dimensionalism’).
Under perdurantism, what exists of me at each moment of my persistence is, strictly speaking, a temporal part of me. And each of my temporal parts is numerically different from all others.
One might be tempted to think that, as a consequence, perdurantism denies that I persist through time. This would be a mistake. While my instantaneous temporal parts do not persist—they exist at one time only—I am not any of those parts. I, as a whole person, am the temporally extended collection, or mereological sum, of all those parts. Hence, I, as a whole person, exist at different times, and thus persist. Compare this with the spatial case. I occupy an extended region of space by having different spatial parts at different places. But I am not numerically identical to those parts. I, as a whole, exist at different places in the sense that in those different places there is a part of me. That is why perdurance implies persistence through time.
We started this article with the question of whether objects persist through time. We have so far presented two theories, and both of them affirm that objects do persist through time. It is now time to introduce a third theory of persistence, the one that consists in the denial of this claim, and that has it that, in place of seemingly persisting objects, there really is a series of instantaneous stages. This theory is called the ‘stage view’, or also ‘exdurantism’. (Stage viewers include Hawley (2001), Sider (1996, 2001), Varzi (2003).)
| Stage view | Ordinary material objects do not persist through time; in place of a single persisting object there really is a series of instantaneous stages, each numerically different from the others. |
The stage view is often confused with perdurantism. The reason is that many contemporary stage viewers believe in a mereological doctrine called ‘universalism’, or also ‘unrestricted fusion’. According to mereological universalism, given a series of entities, no matter how scattered and unrelated, there is an object composed of those entities (see Compositional Universalism). If we combine the stage view with universalism, we get to an ontology in which the stages compose four-dimensional objects which are just like the four-dimensional objects of the perdurantist.
However, the two views are clearly distinct. Here are a few crucial differences. (i) There is, first, a semantic difference: under perdurantism, singular terms referring to ordinary objects, such as “Socrates”, usually refer to persisting, four-dimensional objects, whereas under the stage view, singular terms referring to ordinary objects refer to one instantaneous stage (which particular stage is referred to is determined by the context). So, while under the stage view there might be four-dimensional objects, so-called ordinary objects (such as “Socrates”) are not identified with them, but rather with the stages (Sider 2001, Varzi 2003). (It should be pointed out that significant work is here done by the somehow elusive notion of ‘ordinary object’; see Brewer and Cumpa 2019.) (ii) A second crucial difference has to do with the metaphysical commitment to four-dimensional entities. While perdurantism is by definition committed to four-dimensional entities, the stage view is by definition only committed to the existence of instantaneous stages. If the stage viewer eventually believes in four-dimensional collections of those stages—and she might well not—such a commitment is not an essential part of her theory of persistence. (iii) A third interesting difference has to do with the metaphysical commitment to the instantaneous stages. While this commitment is built into the stage view, it is not built into four-dimensionalism (Varzi 2003). A four-dimensionalist might believe her temporal parts to be always temporally extended and deny the existence of instantaneous temporal parts (for example, because she believes that time is gunky. Incidentally, it is worth noting that from a historical point of view, the guiding intuition of the stage view—namely that objects do not persist through time or change—emerged much earlier than the guiding intuition of four-dimensionalism. While the former can be traced back to, if not Heraclitus, at least the academic skeptics (Sedley 1982), the latter, as far as we know, emerged no earlier than the end of the XIX century (Sider 2001).
b. Locative Theories of Persistence
Here are, again, the definitions of endurantism and perdurantism that we introduced above:
| Endurantism | Ordinary material objects persist by being wholly present at different times; they are three-dimensional entities. |
| Perdurantism | Ordinary material objects persist by having different temporal parts at different times; they are four-dimensional entities. |
One can appreciate the fact that these definitions seem to mix together two aspects of persisting objects (Gilmore 2008). First, there is the mereological aspect. There, the question is whether persisting objects have temporal parts or not. Second, there is an aspect that concerns the shape and size of persisting objects. There, the question is whether persisting objects have a four-dimensional shape, and are temporally extended, or have a three-dimensional shape, and are not extended in time. How can we make sense of these two aspects? What is it for something to be three- or four-dimensional? And how can we make sense of what a temporal part really is? While the latter question is tackled in section § 1d, we shall now focus on the former question concerning shape and extension.
So, what is it for something to be three- or four-dimensional? An illuminating approach to this question—an approach that everyone who wants to work on persistence must be familiar with—comes from location theory (Casati and Varzi 1999, Parsons 2007). We shall thus focus on location first, and then come back to persistence.
Location is here taken to be a binary relation between an entity and a region of a dimension—be it space, time, spacetime—where the entity is in some sense to be found (Casati and Varzi 1999). Location is ambiguous. There is a weak sense, in which you are located at any region that is not completely free of you. In that sense, for example, reaching an arm inside a room would be enough to be weakly located in that room. But there is also a more exact sense, in which you are located at that region of space that is of your shape, size, and that is as distant to everything else as you are—roughly, the region that is determined by your boundaries (Gilmore 2006, Parsons 2007). We shall here follow standard practice and call these modes of location ‘weak location’ and ‘exact location’, respectively.
The intuitive gloss related to exact location suggests that it is interestingly linked to shape, and thus offers us a way of making a more precise sense of what is it for something to be three- or four-dimensional. To be four-dimensional simply is to be exactly located at a four-dimensional spacetime region, while to be three-dimensional is to be located at spacetime regions that are at most three-dimensional. The same gloss helps us make sense of what it is for something to be extended or unextended in time. To be extended in time is for something to be exactly located at a temporally extended spacetime region, while for something to be temporally unextended is for it to be exactly located at temporally unextended spacetime regions only (Gilmore 2006).
At this point, it might be useful to sum up the two aspects mixed together in the definitions of endurantism and perdurantism offered above. We should distinguish: (i) the mereological question of whether persisting objects have temporal parts, and (ii) the locative question of whether objects are exactly located at temporally extended, four-dimensional spacetime regions or rather at temporally unextended, three-dimensional regions only.
| Mereological endurantism | Ordinary persisting objects do not have temporal parts. |
| Mereological perdurantism | Ordinary persisting objects have temporal parts. |
| Locative three-dimensionalism | Ordinary persisting objects are exactly located at temporally unextended regions only. |
| Locative four-dimensionalism | Ordinary persisting objects are exactly located at the temporally extended region of their persistence only. |
Let us explore locative three-dimensionalism further. In particular, we explore here two consequences of the view. First, locative three-dimensionalism has it that objects persist, thus covering a temporally extended region. But they persist by being exactly located at temporally unextended regions. This requires the persisting object to be located at more than one unextended region; more precisely, at all those unextended regions that collectively make up the spacetime region covered during their persistence. Hence, locative three-dimensionalism implies multi-location, that is, the fact that a single entity has more than one exact location (Gilmore 2007). This contrasts with the unique, four-dimensional, spatiotemporal location of an object under locative four-dimensionalism.(Two remarks are in order. First, there is logical space for other locative views as well, but we shall not consider them here. Second, these definitions make use of the notion of persistence, which can now be defined in locative terms as well. Here is a simple way of doing this. Let us define the path of an entity as the mereological sum of its exact locations (Gilmore 2006). An entity persists if its path is temporally extended.)
A second interesting consequence of the view is that, under plausible assumptions, persisting objects will not have temporal parts, for what exists of an entity at a time is the entity itself, exactly located at that time, and not a temporal part thereof. So, under plausible assumptions, locative three-dimensionalism implies mereological endurantism: if something is three-dimensional it does not have temporal parts.
Interestingly, however, being multi-located at instants is not the only way to persist without temporal parts. In principle, something might be exactly located at a four-dimensional, temporally extended spacetime region without dividing into temporal parts. This is the case if the persisting, four-dimensional object is also an extended simple, that is, an entity that is exactly located at an extended region, but is also mereologically simple, in that it lacks any parts (for more on the definition, possibility and actuality of extended simples, see Hudson 2006, Markosian 1998, McDaniel 2003, 2007a, 2007b, Simons 2004). Lacking any parts at all, the persisting object will also lack any temporal parts, thus being mereologically enduring. We shall call simplism this combination between mereological endurantism and locative four-dimensionalism (Costa 2017, Parsons 2000, 2007).
| Simplism | Ordinary persisting objects are mereologically simple and exactly located at the temporally extended region of their persistence only. |
To sum up, making use of some conceptual tools borrowed from location theory allowed us to make better sense of perdurantism and its claim that persisting objects are four-dimensional, temporally extended entities. Moreover, it allowed us to distinguish two forms of endurantism, namely locative three-dimensionalism according to which persisting objects are exactly located at instantaneous, three-dimensional regions of spacetime, and thus lack temporal parts, and simplism, according to which persisting objects are four-dimensional, temporally extended, mereological simples, and thus lack temporal parts.
c. Non-Locative Theories of Persistence
The previous section described two radically different ways of capturing endurantism. Interestingly enough, both of them seem to be committed to controversial claims, such as the actuality of multi-location or of extended simples. Of course, any objection against the actuality of multi-location and of extended simples counts de facto also as an objection against either form of endurantism. We cover some of these objections below. For the time being, suffice it to say that both forms of endurantism are controversial.
Some scholars have taken this result as evidence that endurantism is hopeless (Hofweber and Velleman 2011). But others have taken it as a reason to look for other ways of making sense of endurantism (Fine 2006, Hawthorne 2008, Hofweber and Velleman 2011, Costa 2017, Simons 2000a). So far, we have worked under the standard assumption that it is useful and correct to try to make sense of endurantism in locative terms, that is, under the assumption that the relation between objects and times is the one described in location theory. Some scholars take this assumption to be fundamentally misguided.
Why do they believe this assumption to be fundamentally misguided? One reason might come from intuitions embedded in natural language. Fine (2006), for instance, provides linguistic data in support of the idea that objects and events are in time in fundamentally different ways, which he calls ‘existence’ and ‘extension/location’, respectively (he also offers linguistic data in support of the idea that objects and events are in space in the same way in which events are in time). Moreover, he suggests that two radically different forms of presence might come with different mereological requirements: if something is extended/located at a region, it divides into parts throughout that region, while if something exists at an extended region, it divides into parts throughout that region. Since objects are taken to exist at times instead of being extended/located at times, they will not divide into temporal parts.
Another source of evidence from natural language comes from the attribution of temporal relations (van Fraassen 1970). The intuitive gloss for exact location required any temporally located entity to enter temporal relations. However, it is awkward to attribute temporal relations to objects (consider “Alexander is 15 years after Socrates”) and we would naturally lean towards reinterpreting such attributions as attributions of temporal relations to events (“Alexander’s birth is 15 years after Socrates’ death”). This linguistic data might suggest two intuitions. The first one is that the relation between objects and times should not be the location of location theory. The second one is that the way in which objects are in time is derivative with respect to their events: for an object to exist at a time is for it to be the subject of an event located at that time. Under such a view, the possibility of endurantism coincides with the possibility for a single object to participate in numerically different events (Costa 2017, Simons 2000a).
A different non-locative approach consists in trying to make sense of the endurantism/perdurantism distinction in terms of what is intrinsic to a time (Hawthorne 2006, Hofweber and Velleman 2011). According to this approach, something is wholly present at a time if it is intrinsic to how things are that that very object exists at it (Hawthorne 2006) or if the identity of that object is intrinsic to that time (Hofweber and Velleman 2011). These definitions of wholly present are then plugged into the classic definition of endurance: something endures if it is wholly present at each time of its persistence.
Apart from their being grounded in natural language and intuitions, such views have been motivated on the basis of the controversy of their alternatives. Since both locative forms of endurantism are controversial, these non-locative views should be taken seriously.
d. What is a Temporal Part?
A notion that plays a fundamental role in the definition of perdurantism is the notion of a temporal part. Endurantists have sometimes lamented the notion to be substantially unintelligible (van Inwagen 1981, Lowe 1987, Simons 1987). Hence, it is in the interest of perdurantists to try and clarify it (as well as in the interest of those endurantists who believe that events perdure).
What is a temporal part, such as my present temporal part, supposed to be? First of all, it should be clear that a temporal part is not simply a part that is in time. A spatial part of me, such as my left hand, is certainly not outside time, but it is not a temporal part of mine. It is not, because it is not, in a sense, big enough: a temporal part of mine at a given time must be as big as I am at that time. So, one might be tempted to define a temporal part as a part that is as big as the whole is at the time at which the part is supposed to exist. Moreover, the notion of ‘being as big as’ might be spelled out in terms of spatial location. However, this definition would not do if there are perduring entities that are not in space (such as, for example, a Cartesian mind, or a mental state conceived of as non-spatial event) or if there are parts of objects that are as big as the object is at a time without being temporal parts of it, such as, for example, the shape trope of my body conceived of as something spatially located and as a part of me (Sider 2001). (For tropes and for located properties, see: The Ontological Basis of Properties.)
Sider (2001) offers a standard definition of a temporal part:. It reads:
| Temporal part | x is a temporal part of y at t if (i) x is a part of y at t; (ii) x exists at, and only at, t, (iii) x overlaps at t everything that is part of y at t. |
Let us have a look at each clause in turn. The first one simply says that temporal parts must be parts. The second one ensures that the temporal part exists at the relevant time only. The third one ensures that it includes all of y that exists at that time. (The reader might have noticed that Sider is here using the temporary, three-place notion of parthood—x is part of y at t—instead of the familiar, binary, timeless notion—x is part of y. Here, by ‘timeless’ we simply mean that the notion is not relativized to a time, and not that what exemplifies the notion is in any sense timeless, or outside time. The use of the temporary notion is conceived as a friendly gesture towards the endurantist who usually relativizes the exemplification of properties to times—more on this in § 2a. However, temporal parts might be defined by means of the binary, timeless notion as well. One just needs to replace in the previous definition every instance of the temporary notion with the binary one, and to replace the third clause as (iii*) x overlaps every part of y that exists at t. A second note concerns the fact that Sider’s definition is supposed to work for instantaneous temporal parts. A crucial question then is how, and whether, this definition could be adapted to a metaphysics in which time is gunky (see Kleinschmidt 2017).)
e. Theories of Persistence and Theories of Time
One of the central debates of contemporary metaphysics is the debate as to whether only the present exists, or rather past, present and future all equally exist (Sider 2001). The former view is called ‘presentism’, whereas the latter is called ‘eternalism’ (for more on presentism and eternalism, as well as further alternatives, see: Presentism, the Growing-Past, Eternalism, and the Block-Universe). What are the logical relations between endurantism/perdurantism and presentism/eternalism?
While the combinations of endurantism and presentism, and of perdurantism and eternalism have usually been accepted as possible (for example Tallant 2018), for a long time, it had been supposed that endurantism and eternalism were incompatible with each other. The reasons for this supposed incompatibility are difficult to track down. Summarily, here are two possible reasons. In part, this supposed incompatibility has to do with the so-called problem of temporary intrinsics. In part, it has to do with the idea that eternalism, when combined with spacetime unitism, yields a view in which persisting objects cover a four-dimensional region of spacetime, and thus are four-dimensional and divide into temporal parts (Quine 1960, Russell 1927). Such reasons are now usually discarded. We focus on temporary intrinsics later in § 2a. We have already explained that there are at least two ways in which an object might cover a four-dimensional region of spacetime by being four-dimensional and lacking temporal parts (simplism), or even without being four-dimensional themselves (locative three-dimensionalism). Apart from these locative options, we have also remarked that there are non-locative theories of persistence, and that such theories require the rejection of spacetime unitism. If unitism is successfully rejected, then the problem, if there is one at all, seems not present itself in the first place.
Can one be a perdurantist and also a presentist? A few publications have been devoted to this question, though no conclusive answer has been reached (Benovsky 2009, Brogaard 2000, Lombard 1999, Merricks 1995). On the one hand, one might believe that nothing can be composed of temporal parts if all except one of those parts (namely the past and future ones) do not exist. On the other hand, it has been suggested that one might solve the problem by means of an accurate use of tense operators: while past temporal parts do not presently make part of our ontological catalogue, they did, and maybe their past existence is enough to make them entitled to be parts of a perduring whole.
f. The Persistence of Events
Although contemporary metaphysicians focus mainly on the persistence of objects, there are also parallel debates concerning the persistence of other kinds of entities, such as tropes, facts, dimensions, and, in particular, of events (Galton 2006, Stout 2016). Events are traditionally taken to perdure, for it is intuitively the case that events—such as a football match—divide into temporal parts, such as its two halves. This claim is also accepted by several endurantists, who believe that while objects endure, events perdure. Such a view traces back at least to medieval scholasticism (Costa 2017a). But, once again, the traditional view does not come without dissenters. Contemporary scholars have defended the idea that events or, more precisely, processes endure (Galton 2006, Galton and Mizogouchi 2009, Stout 2016). One reason to believe that at least some entities that are said to be happening endure comes from the fact that we attribute change to them, and that, allegedly, genuine change requires endurance of its subject (Galton and Mizogouchi 2009: 78-81). For example, the very same process of walking might have different speeds at different times. But for change to occur, the numerically same subject, and not temporal parts thereof, must have incompatible properties at different times (heterogeneity of parts is not enough for change to occur). Hence, changing processes must endure. Defenders of enduring processes usually tend to believe that alongside enduring processes there are also perduring events, and sometimes claim that enduring processes are picked out by descriptions that make use of imperfective verbs (such as the walking that is/was/will be happening) while perduring events are picked out by descriptions that make use of perfective verbs (such as the walking that happened/will happen) (Stout 1997: 19). To learn more about the question of whether change requires the endurance of its subject, see the No Change objection against perdurantism, discussed below in § 3b. To learn more about the alleged distinction between processes and events and the related use of (im)perfective verbs, see (Steward 2013, Stout 1997).
2. Arguments against Endurantism
Endurantism has it that objects persist by being wholly present at each instant of their persistence. Thus conceived, objects persist without having temporal parts. Endurantism is usually recognized as the theory of persistence that is closest to common sense and intuition, and thus has sometimes been described as the default view, that is, the view to be held until or unless it is convincingly shown to be hopelessly problematic. So, is endurantism hopelessly problematic?
a. The Argument from Change, a.k.a. from Temporary Intrinsics
A first serious objection against endurantism which traces back to ancient philosophy (Sedley 1982) comes from change. In its simplest form, the objection sounds as follows. Change seems to require difference: if something has changed, it is different from how it was. But if it is different, it cannot be identical, on pain of contradiction. Now, endurantism requires a changing thing to be identical across change, hence, the objection goes, endurantism is false. In this simple form, the objection has a simple answer, that relies on the distinction between qualitative and numerical identity outlined in § 1a. The kind of difference required by change is qualitative difference (not being perfectly identical), and not numerical difference (being two instead of one). Hence, in a change, you might be the same as before (numerical identity) as well as different as before (qualitative difference) without this being contradictory.
This basic argument from change can evolve into two slightly more sophisticated forms. The first form aims to show that even if this analysis of change as numerical identity and qualitative difference is offered, change still results in a contradiction. For change requires a single object—Socrates, say—to have incompatible properties, such as being healthy and sick. But of course, exemplification of incompatible properties leads to a contradiction. For who is sick is not healthy, and hence the numerically same Socrates must be both healthy and not healthy (Sider 2001).
The second slightly more sophisticated form aims to show that change is incompatible with Leibniz’ law, also called the Indiscernibility of Identicals. Leibniz’s law says that numerically identical entities must share all properties. But change thus described is incompatible with Leibniz’s law, for it requires the numerically same entity—such as Socrates at one time and Socrates at another time—not to share all properties—while Socrates at one time is sick, at a later time he is not (Merricks 1994, Sider 2001).
One way to block these two more sophisticated forms consists in rejecting the two guiding principles they rely on. But while this could perhaps more lightheartedly be done with Leibniz’s law, rejecting the Law of Non-contradiction, though not impossible (see Paraconsistent Logic), is certainly not an obviously promising move.
A second way to block these two more sophisticated forms consists in bringing time into the picture. A veritable contradiction and veritable violation of Leibniz’ law would only result from the possession of incompatible properties at the same time. But the incompatible properties of a change are had at the two ends of the change, and hence at two different times.
While this move certainly sounds promising, it is not obvious how time really comes into the picture. Here are two outstanding questions. The first one has to do with the Law of Non-contradiction and Leibniz’s law. When we first introduced them, we did not mention time at all. And in contemporary logic and metaphysics, the two laws are expressed in formulas in which time seems to play no role:
| Law of Non-Contraction (LNC) | ¬ (p ∧ ¬p) |
| Leibniz’ law (LL) | x = y → ∀P (Px ↔ Py) |
Do such principles require a modification in light of the claim that incompatible properties are had at different times?
The second outstanding question has to do with the claim that a changing object has incompatible properties at different times. This seems to require objects to exemplify properties at times. But how is this temporary, or temporally relative, notion of exemplification to be understood (for example, Socrates is sick at time t), especially as opposed to the timeless notion of exemplification (for example, Socrates is sick) (Lewis 1986)? (Once again, here, by “timeless” we simply mean that the notion is not relativized to a time, and not that what exemplifies the notion is in any sense timeless, or outside time.)
Let us begin with the latter question first. What is it for an object to have a property at a time—what is it for, say, Socrates to be sick at time t? To have a look at the other side of the barricade, perdurantism and the stage view seem to have very simple answers to this question. Under the stage view, temporary exemplification is to be analyzed as timeless exemplification by an instantaneous stage: Socrates is sick at t if and only if the instantaneous stage we call Socrates that exists at t is sick (Hawley 2001, Sider 1996, Varzi 2003). Under perdurantism, temporary exemplification is to be analyzed as timeless exemplification by a temporal part: Socrates is sick at t if and only if the temporal part of Socrates that exists at t is sick (Lewis 1986: 203-204, Russell 1914, Sider 2001: 56). So, under perdurantism and the stage view, temporary exemplification is analyzed as timeless exemplification, and therefore there is no need of adapting LNC or LL in any way: the original timeless reading would do.
How would an endurantist make sense of temporary exemplification—of, say, Socrates being sick at time t? We shall here consider a few options. First, notice that if presentism is true, the endurantist too might analyze it in terms of timeless exemplification (Merricks 1995). If t were present, then “Socrates is sick at t” simply would reduce to “Socrates is sick”, full stop. If t were past/future, then “Socrates is healthy at t” would reduce to “Socrates is healthy” under the scope of an appropriate tense-operator, such as: “it was 5 years ago the case that: Socrates is healthy” (for tense operators, see: The Syntax of Tempo-Modal Logic). Moreover, since we cannot infer from “t was 5 years ago the case that: Socrates is healthy” that “Socrates is healthy”, no contradiction or violation of LL follows. However, this solution requires the endurantist to buy presentism.
Second, an endurantist might interpret “Socrates is sick at t” as involving a binary relation—the relation of “being sick at” —linking Socrates and time t (Van Inwagen 1990a, Mellor 1981). This solution does not require us to make any change to the timeless formulations of LNC and LL (it just follows that the relevant instances of LNC and LL will involve relations rather than properties). And, of course, no violation of LNC or LL would follow, insofar as Socrates’ being sick and healthy would be two incompatible relations involving different relata (compare: no contradiction follows from the fact that I love Sam and I do not love Maria). However, this requires a certain deal of metaphysical revisionism. To put it in Lewis’ words, if we know what health is, we know it is a monadic property and not a relation, and we know it is intrinsic and not extrinsic (Lewis 1986: 204) (for intrinsic properties, see: Intrinsic and Extrinsic Properties).
Third, an endurantist might interpret “at t” as an adverbial modifier: when Socrates is sick at t, he exemplifies the property in a certain way, namely t-ly (Johnston 1987, Haslanger 1989, Lowe 1988). If this view of temporary exemplification is accepted, we should also consider more carefully how the original formulations of LNC and LL should be adapted, for the exemplification they involve is temporally unmodified. The task might be more complicated than one might expect (Hawley 2001, 21f). In any case, under certain assumptions, this adverbialist solution makes it the case that change implies no violation of LNC or LL: Socrates is sick and healthy, but in two different ways—t-ly and t’-ly (compare: the fact that I am actually sitting and possibly standing does not imply a contradiction). But, once again, this involves a certain amount of revisionism. For while adverbial modifiers correspond to different ways of exemplifying an attribute, temporal modifiers seem not to correspond to different ways of exemplifying an attribute: for example, standing on Monday and standing on Tuesday seem not to be two different ways of standing.
There are other strategies that the endurantist might use to make sense of temporary exemplification. This is not the place to go through all of them. However, it is worth noting that even if all of them require a bit of revisionism, the endurantist might actually argue the kind of revisionism they involve is less nefarious than the revisionism required to reject endurantism itself (Sider 2001, 98).
b. The Argument from Coincidence
A second objection against endurantism comes from cases in which material objects seem to mereologically coincide—that is, share all parts and— – and locatively coincide— – that is, share the same location—without being numerically identical. If there are such cases, the objection goes, endurantists have a hard time making sense of them, while their alleged problematicity simply disappears if perdurantism or the stage view are assumed (Sider 2001).
What is so bad about mereological and locative coincidence? To start with locative coincidence, it just seems wrong that two numerically different material objects could fit exactly into a single region of space: instead of occupying the same place, they would just bump into each other. It might be the case that some particular kinds of microphysical particles, such as bosons, allow for this kind of co-location (Hawthorne and Uzquiano, 2011). It might also be the case that in some other possible world, with a different set of laws of nature, objects would not bump into each other, but rather pass through each other unaffected, and thus allow for co-location (Sider 2001). However, the ordinary middle-sized objects that populate our everyday life simply do not: they cannot share a same exact location.
Let us now turn to mereological coincidence. What is so bad about it? Suppose x and y share all parts at the same time. If they do, they will surely also happen to be spatially co-located. But if that is the case and they are numerically different, what could account for their numerical difference? What makes them different one from the other, if they have the same parts and the same location? Moreover, contemporary standard mereology—that is, classical extensional mereology—implies that no two objects can share all parts, a principle called ‘extensionality’ (Simons 1987; Varzi 2016).
Let us now consider two possible examples of mereological and locative coincidence. The first one is the case of a statue of Socrates and the lump of clay it is made of. As long as the statue exists, the statue and the lump of clay coincide both mereologically and locatively: they are exactly located at the same spatial region and they share all parts. And yet, there are reasons to believe they are numerically different. For instance, they have different properties. They indeed have different temporal properties: the clay, but not the statue, has the property of existing at times before the statue was created. And they seem to have different modal properties as well: only the clay, and not the statue, can continue to exist even if the clay gets substantially reshaped into, say, a statue of Plato. Since the statue and the lump of clay have different properties, we must conclude that they are numerically different, in virtue of Leibniz’s law.
A second case of coincidence without identity involves Tibbles the cat. As any other cat, Tibbles has a long fury tail. The tail is part of Tibbles just well as the rest of Tibbles—call it Tib—is. Tib is a part of Tibbles, and hence they are numerically different. But suppose that Tibbles loses her tail. It seems that both Tibbles and Tib would survive the accident. After all, cats do not die when losing their tails; and nothing actually happened to Tib when Tibbles lost her tail, so there is no reason to believe that Tib stopped existing. However, after the accident, Tibbles and Tib end up sharing the same exact location and end up sharing all parts. Hence, the case of Tibbles and Tib is yet another case of coincidence without identity.
Is it really the case that the statue is not the lump of clay, and Tibbles is not Tib? These claims might be resisted. For example, if identity is temporary—if x might be identical with y at one time and different at another—then one might say that even if before the accident Tibbles and Tib were different, after the accident they are identical (Gallois 1998, Geach 1980, Griffin 1977). However, this move does not come for free. Serious arguments have been offered to the effect that identity is not a temporary relation (Sider 2001: 165ff, Varzi 2003: 395).
A different option consists in saying that the statue is nothing else than the lump of clay as long as it possesses the property of being arranged statue-of-Socrates-wise (just like Socrates the philosopher is nothing else than Socrates who possess the property of being a philosopher, and certainly not a second person on top of Socrates). In that case, the statue and the lump of clay would not be numerically different (Heller 1990). However, unlike in the case of Socrates becoming a philosopher, it seems that when we create a statue, we have not merely changed something that existed before. Rather, it seems that we created something that did not exist before.
How do perdurantism and the stage view solve the problem of coincidence? Let us start with perdurantism. According to perdurantism, the statue and the piece of clay are four-dimensional objects composed of temporal parts. During the existence of the statue, they might well mereologically and locatively coincide. But since the lump of clay existed before, and will exist after, the statue, the lump has some temporal parts that the statue does not have. Hence, mereologically speaking they do not overall coincide (in fact, from the perdurantist, four-dimensional, perspective, the 4D statue is a part of the 4D lump of clay). Moreover, from a locative point of view, since the lump exists at times at which the statue does not, their spatiotemporal location is not the same. For sure, their spatial location might sometimes be the same; but this is as it should be: if you consider the exact spatial location of your hand, at that location, you and your hand coincide locatively. The same holds for Tibbles and Tib, for they do not mereologically coincide. Tibbles’ tail is a four-dimensional object that only Tibbles, and not Tib, contains as a part (Varzi 2003: 398). On the other hand, the stage viewer, who identifies ordinary objects with stages, will claim that after the creation of the statue, the statue and the piece of clay are numerically identical. Then, she will benefit from the flexibility of the temporal counterpart relation to make sense of the alleged different properties of the statue and the clay. The present clay will outlast the statue not because it will persist for a longer time—the statue is an instantaneous object, it does not persist—but because it has a clay-counterpart at times which are later than the times at which it has its last statue counterpart. The stage viewer will probably adopt a similar answer in the modal case as well. To illustrate, the claim that the clay, and not the statue, can survive reshaping translates into the claim that in a possible world in which the clay is reshaped, the actual clay has a clay-counterpart but not a statue-counterpart (Sider 2001: 194).
What can an endurantist say in cases of coincidence without identity? A first option could be to just bite the bullet: the statue and the piece of clay are indeed numerically different and indeed mereologically and locatively coincident. However, the endurantist will not want to just accept without qualification that different objects can thus coincide. Of course, she will agree, in normal circumstances different objects cannot thus coincide. She will then try to tell apart in a principled way the special cases that allow for coincidence from the normal cases which do not. One popular attempt to trace this difference in a principled way has to do with the notion of constitution. There is a sense, the idea goes, in which the clay constitutes the statue, and in which after the accident Tib constitutes Tibbles. These selected cases in which constitution is in play warrant the possibility—if not the necessity—of mereological and locative coincidence. This endurantist solution to the problem of coincidence is sometimes called the ‘standard account’ (Burke 1992, Lowe 1995). Of course, the standard account does not come for free. It requires one to adopt a theory of mereology different from classical extensional mereology, and a theory of location that allows for co-location, and this might seem to be a drawback in itself. Moreover, a proponent of such a view still has to tell a story on what she takes constitution to be. A much-discussed option is to make sense of constitution in terms of mutual parthood: the statue is part of the clay, and the clay is part of the statue (we are here using the technical notion of proper or improper part, which has numerical identity as a limit case; see Mereological Technicalities). Apart from requiring a substantial revision of even the most endurantist-friendly theories of mereology, appealing to mutual parthood is not yet enough to make sense of constitution. Mutual parthood is symmetrical while friends of constitution take constitution to be asymmetrical: the statue is constituted by the clay, but not vice versa (Sider 2001: 155-156). Contemporary neo-aristotelianism might come to the rescue in answering this question (Fine 1999; Koslicki 2008): constitution might be defined in terms of grounding (for example, one might say that the existence or nature of the clay grounds the existence or nature of the statue) or in hylomorphic terms (the statue is a compound of matter and form, and the clay is its matter).
Further endurantist solutions, to mention a few, include taking identity to be temporary (Gallois 1998, Geach 1980), embracing mereological essentialism (namely the view that changing parts results in the end of persistence; this would help with the case of Tibbles, but not with the case of the clay, which does not necessarily change its parts when arranged into a statue; see Burke 1994, Chisholm 1973, 1975, van Cleve 1986, Sider 2001, Wiggins 1979), or mereological nihilism (namely the view that there are mereologically atomic—that is, partless—objects, so that most if not all of the entities involved in the cases are not part of one’s ontological catalogue (see van Inwagen 1981, 1990a, Rosen e Dorr 2002, Sider 2013).
Apart from trying to respond to the objection, an endurantist could also launch the ball back in the opposite camp and argue that the solution proposed by the perdurantist does not apply in all cases. In the original cases, coincidence was only temporary: there were times at which the two objects did not coincide, either because one did not yet exist (the statue) or because one had a part that the other did not have (Tibbles and her tail). But what about cases in which coincidence is permanent? Consider for example the case in which an artist creates both the statue and the lump of clay at the same time and later on destroys them at the same time. In such a case, the perdurantist’s solution seems to be precluded, for the statue and the piece of clay will share all their temporal parts, so they will end up mereologically and spatiotemporally coinciding (Gibbard 1975, Hawley 2001, Mackie 2008, Noonan 1999). When confronted with such a case, a perdurantist might be forced to accept one of the endurantist’s solutions, and thus will not be allowed anymore to declare her position better off with respect to endurantism. Notice, though, that the perdurantist might actually reply that permanent coincidence does indeed result in numerical identity. After all, if coincidence is permanent, we have lost one of the two reasons to believe that the statue and the piece of clay are numerically different—namely that they existed at different times. Moreover, as regards the difference in modal properties, the perdurantist might just accept the aforementioned solution: the claim that the clay, and not the statue, can survive reshaping translates into the claim that in a possible world in which the clay is reshaped, the actual clay, numerically identical to the statue, has a clay-counterpart but not a statue-counterpart (Hawley 2001). Finally, notice that the problem of permanent coincidence is no problem at all for the stage viewer, who did not appeal to a difference in temporal parts between the statue and the piece of clay to explain coincidence away (Sider 2001).
c. The Argument from Vagueness
A third objection against endurantism comes from the phenomenon of temporal vagueness. Suppose a table is gradually mereologically decomposed: slowly, from top to bottom, one by one, each of the atoms composing it is taken away until, finally, nothing of the table remains. At the end of the process, the table does not exist anymore. So, it must have ceased to exist at some time. But which time? Even if we might have a rough idea of when it happened, it is much more difficult to tell the precise moment in which the table ceased to exist. Recall that we are removing from the table one atom after the other. The removal of which atom is responsible for the disappearance of the table? And how far away must the atom be to count as removed? It seems really hard to give a precise answer to these questions. The case of the disappearance of the table seems somehow to be vague or indeterminate.
How should we make sense of these ubiquitous cases of temporal vagueness or indeterminacy? One option could be to say that the kind of indeterminacy here involved is merely epistemic. This amounts to saying that there is a clear-cut instant at which the table stops existing, and that our inability to determine which one is due to our ignorance of the facts. There is a definitive atom which, once removed, is responsible for the disappearance of the table. Our puzzlement comes simply from the fact that we do not know which one it is. Though some scholars are happy to defend this epistemic option, others find it odd to insist that there must be a precise atom the removal of which results in the disappearance of the table. And that there is a precise distance of the atom from the rest of the table to make it count as removed. Why is it really that atom as opposed to, say, the immediately previous one? What is it so special about that atom that makes the table stop existing? And what is so special about the given distance to be enough to make the atom count as removed? After all, if you look at what remains of the table after the removal of that atom, you would probably be unable to tell any significant difference from what was there before the removal.
A second option could be to say that the kind of indeterminacy here involved does not have to do with our epistemic profile, but rather with the world itself. The reason why it is so difficult to identify a sharp cut-off point at which the table stops existing is that there is no fact of the matter about what this point is. While at some earlier and later times the table definitely does or does not exist, there are some times at which it simply is indeterminate whether the table still exists. Philosophers have always had a hard time in trying to understand ontic or worldly indeterminacy. For a long time, the standard option has been simply to reject this option as impossible (Dummett 1974; Russell 1923; Sider 2001).
However, if the indeterminacy here involved is neither epistemic nor ontic, what is it? Interestingly enough, perdurantism offers a clear way out from this dilemma. The perdurantist will believe that there is a series of four-dimensional entities involved in the case of the disappearing chair. A first four-dimensional entity includes temporal parts up to the point at which the first atom is removed, a second four-dimensional entity includes temporal parts up to the point at which the second atom is removed, and so on until we get to a four-dimensional entity that includes temporal parts up to the point at which only one atom of the table remains. Given this metaphysical picture, the question of the instant at which the table stops existing translates into the question of which of those four-dimensional entities is picked out by the term “table”. While a perdurantist might still say that the kind of indeterminacy here involved is epistemic or ontic, she could also say that it neither has to do with our epistemic limitations nor with the world itself. Rather, she could say that the problem arises because the term “table” is vague. Although the term is used in everyday circumstances, we simply have not made a decision as to how it should work in special circumstances such as the one that we are discussing here. That is where our puzzlement comes from. This kind of indeterminacy results from a mismatch between our language and the world and is therefore semantic in nature.
The endurantist might accept the alleged oddity that comes with interpreting these cases of indeterminacy as either epistemic or ontic and try to live with it. While endurantists have traditionally had a preference for the epistemic option, renewed interest in ontic indeterminacy—due for example to attempts to take canonical interpretations of quantum mechanics at face value—might make the second option a live one as well (Williams and Barnes 2011, Wilson and Calosi 2018). It has also been remarked that the endurantist might in principle mimic the perdurantist solution, along the following lines. The endurantist might posit in place of a single enduring table a series of coinciding enduring objects, each of which ceases to exist slightly later than the other. Such objects will have temporal boundaries that coincide with the nested temporal parts of the perdurantist solution, but unlike them will endure instead of perduring. Having this series of enduring objects in place, the question of the instant at which the table stops existing might translate into the question of which of those enduring entities is picked out by the term “table”. Thus, also for the endurantist this kind of indeterminacy will turn out to be semantic (Haslanger 1994). What can be said about this mimicking strategy? At first, one might be baffled by the sheer number of enduring, coinciding, and table-like entities that the solution requires. However, an endurantist might respond that the number of entities is no more than the one required by the perdurantist solution. In any case, while in the case of the perdurantist the position of this series of entities is part of the view itself, in the case of the endurantist it seems to be a mere strategy to solve the problem of vagueness, and thus it would not be surprising if perdurantists would consider it ad hoc.
d. The Unintelligibility Objection
Endurantism has it that persisting objects are wholly present at each time of their persistence. But what is it for something to be wholly present a time? If no account of this crucial notion is given, endurantism itself remains not properly defined. Moreover, if no account of the notion is possible at all—that is, if we cannot make sense of whole presence—then endurantism itself will turn out to be an unintelligible doctrine. And admittedly endurantists have no easy time in spelling out what whole presence really amounts to (Sider 2001).
Hence, again, what is it for x to be wholly present at time t? It might mean that:
(1) at time t, x has all of its parts.
But what does it mean to say that x has all of its parts? Are we talking about all the parts that x has at t? Or rather about all the parts that x had, has, and will ever have? In both cases, the endurantist is in trouble. In the former case, (1) becomes
(2) at time t, x has all the parts that it has at t.
However, this hardly identifies the endurantist solution alone. The perdurantist too will believe that at any given time, a four-dimensional entity has all the parts it has at that time. Given that the endurantist intended her view to be different from the perdurantist one, this was not what the endurantist had in mind when saying that persisting objects are wholly present at different times. In the latter case, (1) becomes:
| (3) | at time t, y has all the parts that it had, has or will ever have. |
However, recall that according to endurantism persisting objects are supposed to be wholly present at each time of their persistence. If whole presence is defined as in (3), this will imply that objects will never gain or lose parts. Which seems again to mischaracterize endurantism, which was supposed to be compatible with mereological change.
We should point out that in interpreting (1) as (2) or (3) we have switched from an apparently timeless notion of parthood (x is part of y) to a temporary one (x is part of y at time t). The move is a straightforward one for an endurantist to make. Usually, endurantists want their properties or relations—or at least the contingent ones—to be exemplified temporarily. However, at least some endurantists, those who are also presentists, might resist this switch and stick to the timeless notion of parthood. They might simply say that x is wholly present just in case it has all the parts it has, full stop (Merricks 1999). Whether or not this solution works in a presentist setting, it can hardly be applied in a non-presentist one.
Another option might be to argue that to be wholly present simply means to lack any proper temporal parts. This move sounds promising. However, it is not totally uncontroversial, for it has been argued that in special cases an endurantist might want her enduring objects to have proper temporal parts. Suppose, for instance, that an artist creates a bronze statue of Socrates by mixing copper and tin into the mold and then, unsatisfied with the result, destroys the statue by separating tin and copper again, so that the statue and the bronze will begin and cease to exist at the same times. Suppose, further, that the bronze and the statue are numerically different from each other (for reasons why they should be, see § 2b). The bronze might be taken to be a part of the statue (a proper part, insofar as it is different from the whole), but it will mereologically coincide with it during its existence. In this somehow tortuous scenario, even if the bronze and the statue might be conceived as enduring, the bronze will count as a temporal part of the statue at the interval of their persistence. For have a look back at the definition of temporal parts given before:
| Temporal part | x is a temporal part of y at t if (i) x is a part of y at t; (ii) x exists at, and only at, t; (iii) x overlaps at t everything that is part of y at t. |
Indeed, (i) the piece of bronze is a part of the statue that (ii) exists only at the interval for the persistence of the statue, and that (iii) overlaps everything that is part of the statue and exists at that time.
What lesson should we learn from this particular case? According to Sider (2001), a defender of the unintelligibility charge against endurantism, the conclusion to be drawn is that an endurantist might want her enduring objects to have, at least sometimes, proper temporal parts. And that consequently that endurantism cannot simply be the doctrine that objects persist without having proper temporal parts. In principle, one might be tempted to draw a different lesson, that is, that Sider’s definition of temporal parts is unsuccessful and that the notion of a temporal part should be defined in a different way.
In any case, it should be noted that so far, we have tried to characterize the notion of whole presence in mereological terms. However, the reader shall recall that in § 1b we distinguished two aspects which are mixed together in the canonical definition of endurantism offered above. Once again, we should distinguish (i) the mereological question of whether persisting objects have temporal parts, and (ii) the locative question of whether objects are exactly located at temporally extended, four-dimensional spacetime regions or rather at temporally unextended, three-dimensional regions only. So far, in trying to define whole presence in mereological terms, we have assumed that the notion pertained to the mereological question, rather than the locative one. On the other hand, if whole presence is to be characterized in locative terms, the task does not seem to be too difficult (Gilmore 2008, Parsons 2007, Sattig 2006). For example, under the view that we called locative three-dimensionalism, whole presence simply translates as exact location: a persisting object is wholly present at each instant of its persistence in the sense that it is exactly located at each instantaneous time or spacetime region of its persistence.
e. Arguments against Specific Versions of Endurantism
In § 1b and § 1c, we characterized several different versions of locative and non-locative endurantism. Each of them helped characterize better what the endurantist might have had in mind. However, each of them is subject to specific objections, which we here review summarily.
First, we have defined locative three-dimensionalism, according to which persisting objects are exactly located at temporally unextended regions only. This form of endurantism is committed to the possibility of multi-location, that is, to the possibility of a single entity having more than one exact location. Multi-location has been put to work in several contexts, in helping to make sense not only of endurantism, but also of Aristotelian universals and property exemplification, to mention only a few cases. Still, several scholars take multi-location to be problematic, either because it implies contradictions (Ehring 1997a), or because it is at odds with the very notion of an exact location (Parsons 2007), or because it creates specific problems when applied to the case of persistence (Barker and Dowe 2005). Moreover, locative three-dimensionalism is prima facie committed to the existence of instants of time, which cannot be the case if time is gunky (see Leonard 2018).
Second, we have defined simplism, according to which persisting objects are mereologically simple and exactly located at the temporally extended region of their persistence. Simplism is committed to the possibility of extended simples, that is, the possibility that something without any proper parts can be located at an extended region. Extended simples have enjoyed a fair share of popularity and have been argued to be a possibility which flows from recombinatorial considerations (McDaniel 2007b, Saucedo 2011, Sider 2007), from quantum mechanics (Barnes and Williams, 2011) and from string theory (McDaniel 2007a). Still, some scholars look at extended simples with a distrustful stare, because they think that dividing into parts is part of the nature of extension (Hofweber and Velleman 2011), because extended simples are excluded by our best theories of location (Varzi and Casati 1999), or because specific reasons given in favour of the possibility of extended simples are unsuccessful.
Third, we have introduced non-locative versions of endurantism. These versions usually assume that there are two radically different ways of being in a dimension, that objects are in space in a radically different way with respect to the one in which they are in time, and that these two different ways explain why objects divide into spatial but not into temporal parts. Such views are immune from the specific problems of locative three-dimensionalism and of simplism. Still, they have been argued to come with specific drawbacks of their own. In particular, they seem to be at odds with spacetime unitism (see § 1e). Indeed, under spacetime unitism, regions of time and regions of space are simply spatiotemporal regions of some sort. So, it seems that if anything holds a relation to a region of space, it cannot fail to hold the same relation to some region of time as well (Hofweber and Lange 2017).
3. Arguments against Perdurantism
Perdurantism has become a popular option. However, it does not come without its own drawbacks. This section briefly reviews arguments to the effect that that it offends against our intuitions (§ 3a), it makes change impossible (§ 3b), it is committed to mysterious and yet systematic cases of coming into existence ex nihilo (§ 3c), it is ontologically inflationary (§ 3d), it involves a category mistake (§ 3e), it does not make sense (§ 3f), and it has a problem with counting (§ 3g).
a. The Argument from Intuition
Endurantists and their foes alike often agree that endurantism is closer to common sense beliefs, or more intuitive, than perdurantism. Moreover, some philosophers believe that common sense beliefs or intuition should be taken seriously when doing philosophy. This often translates into the idea that such intuitions or beliefs should be preserved as much as possible, that is, until eventually proven false or at least significantly problematic (Sider 2001). Presumably, this is also why endurantism is sometimes considered the champion view, and that the burden of proof in the persistence debate lies on the perdurantist side of the debate (Rea 1998). Now, has endurantism been proven false or significantly problematic? The previous section reviewed several arguments to this effect and registered that several endurantists remain unconvinced. They would therefore conclude that perdurantism is unmotivated and, since it is the challenger view, should be rejected.
We shall not here tackle the question of whether endurantism has been proven false (see § 2 for this). Rather, we focus on other possible ways in which the perdurantist might respond to this specific challenge.
First of all, though, we should wonder: why is endurantism supposed to be more intuitive than perdurantism? What aspects of perdurantism are supposed to be that counter-intuitive? Perdurantism implies that when seeing a tree or talking with a friend, what you have in front of you is not a whole tree or a whole person, but rather only parts of them. It also implies that objects are extended in time just like they are extended in space and a bit like an event is supposed to be. These mereological and locative consequences of perdurantism are supposed to be counter-intuitive: intuitively, we would say that what we have in front of us in the cases described are a whole tree and a whole person, and that we are not extended in time like we are in space, or like events are supposed to be.
Clearly enough, one option for the perdurantist is simply to reject the idea that in philosophy intuitions or common sense should have the weight the endurantist is here proposing. What an endurantist calls “intuitions” a perdurantist might insist are nothing more than unwarranted biases. However, we do not discuss this option here. Tackling the general question of the role of intuition in philosophy goes beyond the scope of this article (for an introduction to the topic, see Intuition).
A second option consists in pointing out that while perdurantism does indeed have counter-intuitive consequences, endurantism is not immune from counter-intuitiveness too. For example, we have already mentioned that several popular versions of endurantism are committed to claims—as the claim that things can have more than one exact location or that extended simples are possible (see § 2e)—which might arguably be taken to be counter-intuitive.
A third option consists in pointing out that even if intuition should play a role in philosophy, the kind of evidence that it offers might be biased, for it might be based on our misleading vantage point on reality. In particular, it might be argued that our endurantist intuitions are based on the fact that human beings commonly experience reality a time after a time. However, if spacetime unitism and eternalism are true, a more veritable perspective would be one that would allow us to perceive the whole of spacetime in a single bird’s-eye view. Were we able to see the whole of spacetime in a single bird’s-eye view, our intuitions might be different, and we might rather be led to believe persisting objects to be spatiotemporally extended, and to see their instantaneous “sections” with which human beings are usually acquainted, as parts of them. In that case, our usual condition would be reminiscent of that of the inhabitants of Flatland, who perceive the passage of a three-dimensional sphere on their plane of perception as the sudden expansion and contraction of a bi-dimensional circle. Once again, here we shall not tackle the question of whether eternalism and spacetime unitism are true (for an introduction to the topic, see Gilmore, Costa, Calosi 2016).
b. The No-Change Objection
A second objection traditionally marshalled against perdurantism is that it makes change impossible (Geach 1972, Lombard 1986, Mellor 1998, Oderberg 2004, Sider 2001, Simons 1987; 2000a). But change quite obviously occurs everywhere and everywhen. Hence, perdurantism is false.
Why would perdurantism make change impossible? Change requires difference and identity. In order for a change to occur, the argument goes, something must be different, that is, must have incompatible properties, but must also be identical, that is, must be one and the same thing. The identity condition is important, for we would not normally call a change a situation in which two numerically different things have incompatible properties. For example, we would not call a change a situation in which an apple is red and a chair is blue. However, the perdurantist account of change (§ 2b) seems committed to invariably violate the identity condition. Under perdurantism, when a change occurs, it is not the numerically same thing which has the incompatible properties. Rather, the incompatible properties are had by numerically different temporal parts of said thing. For example, if a hot poker becomes cold, it is not the persisting poker itself which is hot and cold. Rather, two numerically different temporal parts of it are hot and cold.
Is it really the case that perdurantism violates the identity condition? For sure, under perdurantism, the incompatible properties are had by numerically different temporal parts: an earlier part of the poker is hot, a later one is cold. However, can we not say that the persisting thing has them too: the perduring poker itself is hot and cold? After all, we call red a thing even if not all, but only some, of its parts are red. It is crucial here to stop and wonder what we might mean that the perduring poker itself is hot and cold. One straightforward option would be to say that the poker itself literally is hot and cold, just like its different temporal parts are. However, this is implausible. After all, one of the main motivations for being a perdurantist consists in saying that it is impossible for the numerically same poker to be hot and cold, for it would violate Leibniz’s Law or even the Law of Non-contradiction (§ 2b). Hence, when a perdurantist says that the perduring poker itself is hot and cold she must mean something different. Presumably, she means that the poker is hot insofar as it has hot parts and is cold insofar as it has cold parts. However, if this is what the perdurantist really means, she would presumably be violating the difference condition. For change requires the same subject to have incompatible properties. Whereas having hot parts and having cold parts are not incompatible properties.
A second and popular move consists in rejecting the identity condition. Change does not require one and the same thing to have incompatible properties. At least in some cases, different things would do too (Sider 2001). However, foes of perdurantism would insist that it is not possible to give up the identity condition so lightly. They would insist, for example, that having parts with incompatible properties is insufficient for change. For example, a single poker would not change for the simple fact of having hot parts and cold parts: mereological heterogeneity is not change. Perdurantists might concede that mereological heterogeneity is not always change, but specify that under certain circumstances, it is. In particular, mereological heterogeneity is change in cases where incompatible properties are had by different temporal parts of a single thing.
Some endurantists remain unconvinced by this proposed amendment to the identity condition. They would say, for example, that since temporal parts are numerically different from each other, under perdurantism there is no change, but only replacement. At this point, perdurantists have at least two options. The first one is simply to disagree: change is a particular kind of replacement. The second one consists in giving up on change: if change really requires the original identity condition, then let it be: philosophy has taught us that where we believed there to be change, there really only is replacement (Simons 2000b; Lombard 1994).
c. The Crazy Metaphysic Objection
A third objection against perdurantism is that it is a “crazy metaphysic”, for it involves systematic and yet mysterious cases of coming into existence. The objection refers here to the fact that, under perdurantism, new temporal parts of a single thing come into (and go out of) existence continuously. As Thomson famously puts it:
[perdurantism] seems to me a crazy metaphysic (…). [It] yields that if I have had exactly one bit of chalk in my hand for the last hour, then there is something in my hand which is white, roughly cylindrical in shape, and dusty, something which also has a weight, something which is chalk, which was not in my hand three minutes ago, and indeed, such that no part of it was in my hand three minutes ago. As I hold the bit of chalk in my hand, new stuff, new chalk keeps constantly coming into existence ex nihilo. That strikes me as obviously false (Thomson 1983, 213).
Under perdurantism, these cases of coming into being really are systematic. But what does it mean to say that they are crazy or mysterious? It might mean that they do not make sense (for this option, see the unintelligibility objection in § 3e). But there is another option which is worth exploring. According to this option, mystery has to do with the absence of an indispensable explanation. If perdurantism is true, the objection goes, there are systematic cases of coming into existence. These cases cry out for an explanation: how is it that these new things come into existence? Where do they come from? However, perdurantism seems to be unable to offer an explanation for these cases. Under perdurantism, the systematic coming into being of new and new temporal parts is a brute fact, of which there is no explanation.
First, we shall wonder: is perdurantism really unable to offer an explanation for these cases of coming into existence? Thomson seems to be persuaded that it cannot. If perdurantism is true, these temporal parts do not come from a source which might explain their appearance. In her words, they come into existence ex nihilo. But is this really the case? What does it mean that a new temporal part of a thing comes into existence ex nihilo, from nothing? Does it mean that nothing existed before the temporal part? Certainly not: other temporal parts of the thing existed before the appearance of that particular temporal part. Does it mean that the coming into existence of the temporal part is an event which has no cause? Again, this seems to be implausible. If perdurantists take causation seriously (for if they do not, the objection would not apply in the first place, see (Russell 1913)), some perdurantists would say that there is a causal connection between temporal parts of a single thing: the later ones are caused to exist by the previous ones (Heller 1990, Oderberg 1993, Sider 2001). Endurantists might disagree here. For example, they might believe that later temporal parts cannot be caused to exist by the previous ones, for (immediate) causation requires simultaneity of cause and effect (see Huemer and Kovitz 2003, Kant 1965).
We have discussed how a perdurantist might try to offer an explanation for the continuous coming into existence of new temporal parts. But is it really the case that the coming into existence of new temporal parts really requires an explanation? In that connection, perdurantists usually follow two lines of reasoning. First, they argue that the succession of new temporal parts as we move through time is analogous to the succession of new spatial parts as we move through space. And since we do not think there is anything mysterious in the latter case, so we should have the same attitude in the former one as well (Heller 1990, Varzi 2003). This argument from analogy gains plausibility especially under a unitist view of spacetime. However, one might argue that the analogy fails, for example because causation unfolds diachronically over time and not synchronically through space, so we have a reason not to expect there to be an explanation in the spatial case and to require an explanation in the temporal one instead. The second line of reasoning takes the form of a tu quoque. Thomson believes that the continuous coming into existence of new temporal parts requires an explanation. But is the continuous existence of an enduring object not equally mysterious? How is it that an enduring object continues to exist instead of ceasing to exist? If the endurantist’s continuous existence is no mystery, so also is the continuous coming into existence of new temporal parts proposed by the perdurantist (Sider 2001, Varzi 2003).
d. The Objection from Ontological Commitment
One criterion that has been sometimes employed in order to evaluate metaphysical doctrines is Ockham’s razor, according to which a theory should refrain from making commitments if such commitments are not necessary to its theoretical success. One particular kind of commitment is ontological commitment, that is, the commitment of a theory to the existence of entities of kinds thereof. According to Ockham’s razor, this commitment is to be avoided if possible, and any theory which is less ontologically committed is, ceteris paribus, preferable with respect to one which has more ontological commitment (see The Razor).
Now, it might be noted that perdurantism is committed to the existence of a higher number of entities with respect to both endurantism and the stage view. Perdurantism is more ontologically committed than endurantism, for on top of a single persisting thing, it is committed to the existence of a series of numerically different temporal parts thereof. Perdurantism is also more ontologically committed than the stage view. Indeed, unlike perdurantism, the stage view is not necessarily committed to the existence of the perduring mereological sums of the instantaneous stages. If perdurantism is indeed more ontologically committed than endurantism and the stage view, the question is whether this commitment is really necessary. This question is of course discussed in § 2 and § 4. However, more generally, the perdurantist might wish to reject Ockham’s razor—for what reasons do we have to believe that the world is not more complex than our simplest theories? —or to ride the wave of contemporary metaphysicians which simply downplays the importance of ontological commitment, and suggests that the fundamental question of metaphysics is not what there is, but rather what is fundamental, or what grounds what (Schaffer 2009). Yet another response on behalf of the perdurantist is based on the distinction between quantitative and qualitative parsimony (Lewis 1973; 1986). A metaphysical system is more quantitatively parsimonious the fewer entities it acknowledges, while it is more qualitatively parsimonious the fewer ontological categories it introduces. Offending against quantitative parsimony is often considered to be less problematic, if at all, than offending against qualitative parsimony. And indeed, one might say, perdurantism offends against quantitative, but not qualitative, parsimony, for each temporal part of a material object is itself a material object.
e. The Category Mistake Argument
Perdurantism has it that persisting objects have temporal parts. This makes objects similar to events, for events too are also usually taken to have temporal parts. Because of this similarity, perdurantists have sometimes presented as a consequence of their view that objects and events are entities of the same kind, and the difference between events and objects is, at best, one of degree of stability (Broad 1923, Quine 1970). In the words of Nelson Goodman (1951, 357): “a thing is a monotonous event, an event is an unstable thing”.
Are events and objects entities of the same kind? Critics of perdurantism have sometimes argued that they are not, and that conflating objects and events would result in a serious category mistake. Perdurantism, which is committed to this mistake, would therefore need to be rejected. This is the category mistake argument against four-dimensionalism (Hacker 1982, Mellor 1981, Strawson 1959, Wiggins 1980).
What reasons are there to believe that events and objects belong to different ontological categories? For example, it has been pointed out that while objects are said to exist, events are said to happen, or take place (Cresswell 1986, Hacker 1982). This linguistic difference is sometimes said to be a reflection of an ontological one, that is, that objects and events enjoy different modes of being. Moreover, while objects exist at times and are at places, events are supposed to be at places and times. Once again, this linguistic difference is supposed to reflect an ontological one, that is, that objects and events relate to space and time in radically different ways (Fine 2006). Furthermore, objects do not usually allow for co-location, at least not to the extent in which events do (Casati and Varzi 1999, Hacker 1982). Finally, it is sometimes said that the spatial boundaries of events are usually vaguer than those of objects (what are the spatial boundaries of a football match?), whereas the temporal boundaries of events are usually less vague than those of objects (Varzi 2014).
A first way to resist this argument is to insist that conflating objects and events is no category mistake. Putative differences between objects and events will then either be considered irrelevant when it comes to metaphysics—for example because they are merely linguistic differences which do not reflect any underlying significant difference in reality—or in any case not enough to imply that objects and events belong to different ontological categories. After all, presumably, not all differences between kinds of entities are supposed to make them entities of a different kind (Sider 2001).
On the other hand, if a perdurantist is persuaded that conflating objects and events would be a category mistake, she could simply reject the claim that perdurantism implies that objects are events or vice versa. Perdurantism is the claim that objects have one feature that is usually—and not universally—attributed to events, that is, having temporal parts. And sharing some features is not a sufficient condition to belonging to the same ontological category. After all, entities of other kinds, such as time intervals or spacetime regions, are usually taken to have temporal parts without being events.
f. The Unintelligibility Objection
Some endurantists believe that perdurantism is not (only) false, but utterly unintelligible. According to this possible objection, perdurantism is a “mirage based on confusion” (Sider 2001, 54), a doctrine which makes “no sense” (Simons 1987, 175) or which is, at best, “scarcely intelligible” (Lowe 1987, 152). In the trenchant words of Peter van Inwagen:
I simply do not understand what [temporal parts of ordinary objects] are supposed to be, and I do not think this is my fault. I think that no one understands what they are supposed to be, though of course plenty of philosophers think they do. (van Inwagen 1981, 133)
In response to this objection, David Lewis (1986) famously stated that if one is unable to understand a view, one should not debate about it. Colorful as it is, Lewis’ stance misfires. The point of the objection is not that the objector has not understood perdurantism, but rather that perdurantism itself is unintelligible. Lewis’ point would apply in case where the objector was simply admitting her epistemic limitations. But the objector is not making a point about herself. Rather, she is making a point about the view itself, saying that it does not make sense. (Is it possible for something to be false and also not to make sense? Several scholars have indeed endorsed the view that some claims, such as contradictions or category mistakes, are false and do not make sense. But this view might be attacked.)
What is it precisely that is supposed not to make sense in perdurantism? Is it the notion of a temporal part itself? This is hardly the crux of the problem, since many endurantists claim that the notion itself, when applied to events, makes perfect sense (Lowe 1987). The unintelligibility of the view should rather come from some other aspect of the view. But if so, wherefrom? One option consists in saying that the unintelligibility comes from the fact that perdurantism is committed to a category mistake, and category mistakes, or at least some of them, are unintelligibile (for a discussion see § 3e). A second option might have to do with mereology. Indeed, Sider (2001), who takes the objection seriously, considers that the problem might lie in the fact that the notion of a temporal part is usually defined in terms of the timeless notion of parthood—x is part of y. Rather, endurantists tend to use the temporary notion of parthood—x is part of y at t. Sider suggests that maybe the sense of unintelligibility comes from the fact that perdurantists tend to use a mereological notion that endurantists take to be unintelligible—or to yield unintelligible claims when applied to everyday material objects. If Sider’s diagnosis is correct, then his definition of temporal parts in terms of temporary parthood discussed before (§ 1d) seems to take care of it.
g. The Objection from Counting
The objection from counting is traditionally presented as an objection against perdurantism and in favor of the stage view. The semantic difference between the two views is of particular importance here. Recall that the two views disagree about the reference of expressions referring to ordinary objects. Under perdurantism, expressions referring to ordinary objects, such as “Socrates”, refer to persisting, four-dimensional objects, whereas under the stage view, expressions referring to ordinary objects refer to one instantaneous stage (which particular stage is referred to is determined by the context).
Let us consider again the case of the statue and the piece of clay (§ 2b). Under perdurantism, both of them are four-dimensional entities, and their apparent coincidence boils down to their sharing some temporal parts. In particular, at any time in which the statue exists, there is an instantaneous statue-shaped entity that is both a temporal part of the statue and a temporal part of the piece of clay. Now suppose that at that particular time someone asks the question: how many statue-shaped objects are there? Intuitively, we would like to answer that there is only one. And this is the answer given by the stage view. For the stage view takes ordinary expressions such as “statue-shaped object” to refer to instantaneous stages, and there is only one of them that exists at that time. On the other hand, perdurantism counts by four-dimensional entities. And since that particular instantaneous stage is a temporal part of two ordinary objects, the statue and the piece of clay, perdurantism implies that there are in fact two statue-shaped objects there at that time. Hence, perdurantism, unlike the stage view, yields unwelcome results as regards the number of entities involved in such cases. This is the argument from counting against perdurantism (Sider 2001).
A possible answer consists in saying that in that particular context the predicate “statue-shaped object” does indeed refer to two four-dimensional entities, the statue and the piece of clay, but that we count them as one because they are, in a sense, identical at the time of the counting (Lewis 1976). In saying so, we are using an apparently time-relative notion of identity—x is identical to y at t—instead of the usual timeless one—x is identical to y. What does that mean? A four-dimensionalist would define the time-relative notion in terms of the timeless one: x is identical to y at t if the temporal part of y at t is identical to the temporal part of y at t. Stage theorists will probably remain unconvinced by this move for, they would insist, counting can only be done by identity. In Sider’s words: “I doubt that this procedure of associating numbers with objects is really counting. Part of the meaning of ‘counting’ is that counting is by identity; ‘how many objects’ means ‘how many numerically distinct objects’ (…). Moreover, the intuition that [there is just one statue-shaped object at that time] arguably remains even if one stipulates that counting is to be identity” (Sider 2001, 189).
4. Arguments against Stage View
This section reviews arguments against the stage view, to the effect that it goes against our intuitions (§ 4a), it makes change impossible (§ 4b), it is committed to mysterious and yet systematic cases of coming into existence ex nihilo (§ 4c), it is ontologically inflationary (§ 4d), it is incompatible with temporal gunk (§ 4e), it is incompatible with our mental life (§ 4f) and it has problems with counting (§ 4g).
a. The Argument from Intuition
In § 3a we discussed the argument from intuition against perdurantism. A similar argument has been proposed against the stage view as well. While the details of the present argument are somewhat different from the previous one, its general structure remains the same. The general idea is that closeness to intuitions or common sense constitutes a theoretical advantage that a view might have. And, the objector says, both endurantism and perdurantism are closer to intuitions than the stage view.
Why is the stage view supposed to be especially counter-intuitive? Presumably, the aspect of the stage view which offends the most against our intuitions is the fact that it denies persistence. Indeed, while endurantism and perdurantism agreed on the fact that some ordinary objects persist, either by enduring or by perduring, the stage view denies that ordinary objects persist. In place of a single persisting object, the stage view posits a series of numerically different instantaneous stages.
In order to tackle this objection, the stage viewer might decide to deploy some of the generic strategies outlined in § 3a. First, the stage viewer might insist that intuitions are no more than biases and thus deny that that intuitions place any disadvantage on the stage view. Second, the stage viewer might believe that the disadvantage exists, but is nevertheless outweighed, either by the fact that other views are intrinsically counter-intuitive too (see again § 3a), or by the fact that the other views have been proven false or at least significantly problematic.
Here, however, we focus on a fourth and more specific strategy available to the stage viewer. The strategy consists in arguing that the intuition that is supposed to disfavor the stage view does not really disfavor it. It is indeed true, the stage viewer would say, that we commonly have beliefs such as “I was once a child”. The critic of the stage viewer takes them to imply the persistence of the self, for how could I have been a child without existing in the past? But this, the stage viewer says, is a mistake. In fact, we could make sense of beliefs such as “I was once a child” just as well by means of the counterpart relation: “I was once a child” is true if a past counterpart of mine is a child. In other words, those beliefs are undetermined with respect to the question of whether things exist at more than one time (Sider 2001).
A possible reply is that the strategy might not be applied to all putative cases of commonsensical beliefs involving the past. Consider for example a tenseless statement of cross-time identity such as “I am identical to a young child”, in which I affirm my identity with my previous self. This statement cannot be taken care of in terms of counterparts. The stage viewer’s rejoinder might here be that these beliefs are perhaps too technical to be common sense or that, in any case, what really matters is that the stage viewer is able to make sense of and to validate cognate statements that are framed in terms which are much more mundane, such as “I was once a child” (Sider 2001).
b. The No-Change Objection
In § 3b we discussed the no-change objection against perdurantism. The objection was that change requires the numerical identity of the subject of change before and after the process of change. There, we discussed the option of amending this identity requirement. Change does not require that the subject before and the subject after the change be identical. They just need to be temporal parts of a single thing. The stage viewer might adopt this strategy to suit her needs. Change does not require that the subject before and the subject after the change be identical. They just need to be related by the counterpart relation. Some endurantists remain unconvinced by the perdurantist amendment. We might reasonably expect them to be unconvinced by the amendment proposed by the stage viewer too. Since the relevant stages are numerically different from each other, under the stage view there is no change, but only replacement. The stage viewer’s rejoinder might be either to insist that change is a particular kind of replacement or to give up on change and insist that there is nothing bad in saying that where we believed there to be change, there really is replacement.
c. The Crazy Metaphysic Objection
Section 3c reviewed an argument against perdurantism to the effect that it involved systematic and yet mysterious cases of coming into existence. The stage view is subject to a similar objection. Just like perdurantism requires the systematic coming into existence of new temporal parts, so the stage view requires the systematic coming into existence of new instantaneous stages. And if perdurantism did not have a plausible explanation for this systematic coming into existence, neither does the stage view.
However, it should also be noted that the stage viewer can apply the exact same strategies there proposed on behalf of the perdurantist. The stage viewer might insist that there indeed is an explanation for the coming into existence of new temporal parts. Their coming into existence is caused by the previous stages (Varzi 2003). Or she might argue that the systematic coming into existence is not mysterious after all, for it is no more mysterious than the succession of spatial parts through space, and no more mysterious than the continuous existence of an enduring object through time (Sider 2001; Varzi 2003).
d. The Objection from Ontological Commitment
Section § 3d reviewed an argument from ontological commitment against perdurantism. Its guiding principle was that unnecessary ontological commitments should be avoided and, therefore, any theory which is less ontologically committed is, ceteris paribus, preferable with respect to one which has more ontological commitment.
This kind of argument seems to disfavor the stage view with respect to endurantism. Indeed, instead of a single enduring thing, the stage view posits a myriad of numerically different instantaneous stages. However, this kind of argument does not disfavor the stage view with respect to perdurantism. Indeed, often the ontological commitments of the stage view and of perdurantism are perfectly aligned. Indeed, because of their commitment to mereological universalism, many stage viewers believe in the existence of four-dimensional aggregates on top of instantaneous stages (see § 1a). However, the stage view is not committed to four-dimensional aggregates by definition. So, depending on further metaphysical parameters, it might turn out that a stage viewer’s overall metaphysical view ends up being less ontologically committed than perdurantism.
In order to block this kind of argument, the stage viewer might adopt the usual strategies already described on behalf of the perdurantist. In particular, she might argue that the further ontological commitments of the stage view is fully justified because of the failures of endurantism (§ 2), or she might argue that a philosopher should not be scared to make all the ontological commitments that she sees fit, for what reasons do we have to believe that the world is not more complex than our simplest theories? Finally, she could ride the wave of contemporary metaphysicians which simply downplays the importance of ontological commitment and suggests that the fundamental question of metaphysics is not what there is, but rather what is fundamental, or what grounds what (Schaffer 2009).
e. The Objection from Temporal Gunk
When introducing the stage view, we pointed out that unlike perdurantism and endurantism, its very definition commits it to the existence of instantaneous entities. This might be a drawback of the stage view, in case time turns out to be gunky, that is, if it turns out that every temporal region can be divided into smaller temporal regions, and thus, temporal instants turn out not to exist (Arntzenius 2011, Whitehead 1927, Zimmerman 2006).
We do not here focus on the question of whether there exist temporal instants at all. Instead, we shall briefly remark that, as it stands, the argument implicitly assumes that if there are no instants, there cannot be instantaneous entities. This assumption might be taken to follow from a series of principles of location, most notably the principle of exactness, according to which anything that is in some sense in a dimension must also have an exact location in that dimension. Now, located entities share shape and size with their exact locations. Hence, if exactness is true, instantaneous entities do indeed require the existence of instants in order to exist. However, exactness has come under attack on different grounds, one of which concerns indeed the possibility of pointy entities in gunky dimensions (Gilmore 2018, Parsons 2001). Hence, it seems in principle possible for a stage viewer to uphold her view even if she takes time to be gunky.
f. The Objection from Mental Events
There is an objection often proposed against the stage view which concerns in particular the persistence of subjects of mental states. The stage view implies that ordinary objects, persons included, do not persist through time. However, some mental processes and states seem not to be possibly performed or possessed by instantaneous entities. For example, we say that people reflect on some ideas, make decisions, ponder means, act, fall in love, change their mind. All those mental events take time, and thus cannot possibly be possessed by instantaneous stages. (Brink 1997, Hawley 2001, Sider 2001, Varzi 2003).
The stage viewer will typically reply that acting, reflecting, pondering, making decisions and so on do not require a persisting subject. For example, they might insist that, say, acting is something that can be possessed by a stage in virtue of its instantaneous state as well as in virtue of its relations to its previous stages, provided that the previous stages possess their appropriate mental properties (Hawley 2001, Sider 2001, Varzi 2003). Alternatively, the stage viewer might insist that there are indeed extended mental events such as acting or pondering, but that such mental states do not have one single subject, but rather a series of subjects which succeed themselves one after the other. For each of them, to be acting is to be the subject of an instantaneous temporal part of a temporally extended event of acting. In any case, the stage viewer will concede that her view, unlike endurantism and perdurantism, is incompatible with the idea that such mental events are temporally extended and are possessed by a single subject.
g. The Objection from Counting
Section § 3g discussed an objection against perdurantism to the effect that it delivered the wrong counting results in cases of mereological coincidence. To the question “how many statue-shaped objects are there?”, asked at a time in which the piece of clay and the statue mereologically coincide, the perdurantist has to answer that there are two, whereas the stage viewer can give the intuitive answer that there is only one. However, while considerations about counting in cases of coincidence seem to favor the stage view, similar considerations in cases which are far more common seem to disfavor the stage view over its rivals, and endurantism in particular. Suppose Sam remains alone in a room for an hour. How many people have been in that room during that hour? Intuitively, we would like to answer that there has been only one. And this is the answer given by endurantism. For endurantism takes Sam to be one single persisting object that exists through the hour. On the other hand, the stage view takes ordinary expressions such as “person” to refer to instantaneous stages, and there is such an instantaneous stage of Sam for each instant making up the hour. Hence, the stage view, unlike endurantism, yields unwelcome results as regards the number of entities involved in such cases (Sider 2001). (How does perdurantism fare with this objection? It depends on whether it counts temporal parts of persons as persons. If it does (and it usually does, see § 2b), perdurantism is subject to the same objection.)
Suppose that the stage viewer is concerned with this problem and takes intuitions about counting seriously (and she arguably should, if she endorses the argument from counting in favor of her view presented in § 3g). In that case, the stage viewer has at least three options. The first one consists in saying that in that particular context the predicate “person” does indeed apply to several instantaneous stages, but that we count them as one because they are counterparts of each other. This option is subject to a rejoinder which was already employed in § 3g against the Lewisian solution to the problem of counting in favor of the stage view. Indeed, the present option suggests that sometimes we count by counterparthood and not by identity. This offends against the view that “part of the meaning of ‘counting’ is that counting is by identity” (Sider 2001, 189). A second option is available to the stage viewer who believes in the existence of four-dimensional sums of instantaneous stages. This stage viewer might claim that in the present context the predicate “person” applies to one single four-dimensional object instead of the instantaneous stages. In so doing, the stage viewer is adopting an unorthodox view which mixes the stage view and perdurantism, in which reference of ordinary terms such as “person” is flexible: sometimes they pick out instantaneous stages (as in the stage view), sometimes they pick out four-dimensional sums thereof (as in perdurantism). A third and final option consists in taking domains of counting to be restricted to entities existing to the time of utterance, or restricted in some other suitable way (Viebahn 2013).
5. What Is Not Covered in this Article
This section lists several aspects and issues concerning the metaphysics of persistence that are not covered in this article. Each of them is complemented with some references so as to guide readers in their exploration.
When it comes to the characterization of the views and of the debate, it is worth noting that some philosophers have tried to characterize the endurantism/perdurantism dispute in terms of explanation (Donnelly 2016; Wassermann 2016), while others have argued that the dispute is not substantial, but rather merely verbal (Benovsky 2016; Hirsch 2007; McCall and Lowe 2003; Miller 2005). It is also worth noting that apart from a few introductory words, not much has been covered about the history of the metaphysics of persistence (Carter 2011; Costa 2017; 2019; Cross 1999; Helm 1979).
When it comes to arguments for and against the various metaphysics of persistence, a couple of traditional arguments against perdurantism have not been covered in § 3, namely the modal argument (Heller 1990; Jubien 1993; van Inwagen 1990a; Shoemaker 1988; Sider 2001) and the rotating disk argument (Sider 2001). Moreover, it is important to note that several arguments have been drawn from physics for and against theories of persistence presented in this article, among which figure several arguments against endurantism, namely the shrinking chair argument (Balashov 2014; Gibson and Pooley 2006; Gilmore 2006; Sattig 2006), the explanatory argument (Balashov 1999; Gibson and Pooley 2006; Gilmore 2008; Miller 2004; Sattig 2006), the location argument (Gibson and Pooley 2006; Gilmore 2006; Rea 1998; Smart 1972), the superluminar objects argument (Balashov 2003, Gilmore 2006, Hudson 2005; Torre 2015), the invariance argument (Balashov 2014; Calosi 2015; Davidson 2014) as well as an argument from quantum mechanics against perdurantism (Pashby 2013; 2016).
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Author Information
Damiano Costa
Email: damiano.costa@usi.ch
University of Italian Switzerland (Universita’ della Svizzera Italiana, University of Lugano)
Switzerland