The Cambridge Platonists

The Cambridge Platonists were a loose collection of proto-idealist, humanistic philosophers who were active in England during the mid-to-late 1600’s. Most were teachers associated with Emmanuel College, the most radical of the Calvinist colleges at Cambridge University. They applied what they understood to be Plato’s Rationalism in order to moderate several intellectual controversies occurring at their time while avoiding direct and dangerous political commentary. They were also among the first philosophers to publish in English.

The actual term “Cambridge Platonists” is historiographic. It was coined in the nineteenth century. Thus, any stipulation of the “membership” of this group is post facto, and, possibly, ad hoc. But such lists generally include Benjamin Whichcote, Ralph Cudworth, Henry More, Peter Sterry, John Smith, and Nathaniel Culverwell. Contemporaries often referred to these thinkers as “The Latitude Men,” or “Latitudinarians,” marking their shared encouragement of religious tolerance. Joseph Glanville has also been considered a Latitude Man, though he taught at Oxford, and he was not particularly focused on philosophical matters, preferring science and theology. More recently, Damaris Cudworth Masham and Ann Conway have been classed as “Cambridge Platonists,” due to their philosophical similarities to, and close associations with, others more clearly among the Platonists. But they, as women, were never allowed to attend or teach at Cambridge. Also, due to their youth, they applied their work to their own generation’s concerns, not to those of the period when England had no monarch (1649–1660), on which the other Platonists focused.

The Platonists’ influence has been detected in the work of several other thinkers. These include John Locke, Anthony Cooper, Gotfried Leibniz, Samuel Clarke, and Samuel Taylor Coleridge. More controversially, Cudworth and More have been seen as influencing the works of Isaac Newton and the German Idealist movements.

Influences on the Cambridge Platonists
Significant Cambridge Platonists
Central Beliefs of the Cambridge Platonists
The Influences of the Cambridge Platonists on Others
References and Further Readings

1. Influences on the Cambridge Platonists

a. Calvinism

The Cambridge Platonists were generally raised as Calvinists. But, despite this, they saw danger in some of Calvinism’s more radical positions. And so, they sought a way to moderate them to allow for free will, reason, and some possibility of moral dignity in common humanity (Tulloch, especially I, pp. 1-20, 63-260).

For example, the Calvinists were “Voluntarists.” This means that they saw God’s Omnipotence as being His dominant characteristic. To them, His power was not even constrained by Logic. Instead, Reason and Logic conformed to His will. And so, there is no reason why He chooses anything at any time. A contemporary thinker might see His actions as operating in a manner analogous to Existentialist Absurdity. Ralph Cudworth referred to this as “The Theory of the Arbitrary Deity.” (Cudworth, True Intellectual System of the Universe, p. 529) The Platonists saw Omniscience as the dominant characteristic of God, with Logic and Reason being manifestations, so that both Logic and Reason constrained and defined His power. He was obliged to accept that two plus two equals four, because He knows this is true, due to His Omnipotence, and this trumped his Omnipotence. (More, Explanation, I, p. 72)

Moreover, in the Westminster Confession of Faith (1643), it was stated that humans had Free Will in choosing between “natural goods,” such as whether one might prefer apple or cherry pie, for example, but none over “spiritual goods,” such as between Good and Evil. Thus, they were Determinists, at least in terms of the ethics. These choices all belonged to God (Westminster, IX, p.3). And so, Calvinists believed that natural human character was irredeemably corrupt. Without divine amendment to its nature, humanity’s identity as not-God made each person that was unamended by God, totally ethically depraved. There was nothing that any human might do to correct this state. The character and ultimate fate of each soul were utterly dependent upon Divine Providence, which was, as has been said, arbitrary.

Finally, Voluntarism implied that Reason was useless in understanding God or anything He did. So only spontaneous, pre-rational divine revelation was a possible source for these truths, or of any knowledge concerning such “spiritual goods” such as Ethics, Theology, or Theocratic Politics. So, Calvinists were invulnerable to any sober, rational consideration and interpretation on these matters (Tulloch, pp. 14-18).

Critics of Calvinism came to refer to this position as “Enthusiasm,” from the Ancient Greek phrase “to have a god within one.” The implications that carried over in this word, from the Greek, were that the Enthusiast was either possessed or insane. A more sympathetic interpreter might call the Enthusiast a prophet, or a poet, but “Enthusiasm” was specifically used by enemies of the Calvinists. It was not their term.

When the Calvinists won control of England in the English Civil War (1642–1651), they were required to establish a new social order to replace the one that they had overturned. Unfortunately, they were unable to find any common ground on any subject that mattered with anyone with whom they disagreed, even within their own movement. Each Calvinist attributed all his or her core beliefs to God. This left them no higher ground from where disputes might be amicably debated and adjudicated. They were obliged to conclude that anyone who did not see them as speaking with the authority of a prophet, and taking the other side of any debate, was totally and irredeemably evil, either ignoring God, or being ignored by Him, which was effectively the same thing (Ibid., especially pp. 8-15, 63-75,181-195).

This did not allow for peace between Calvinist factions in England during their rule. It was eventually replaced by the nominally Calvinist “Lord Protectorate,” which was really a strong-man government under Oliver Cromwell (1653–1658). When he died, it collapsed, and the Parliament asked the old royal family to return and become the rallying point around which social order may be reestablished (1660). During the Interregnum, the troubled time of Calvinist and Cromwellian rule, the Cambridge Platonists sought to find a less radical, more intellectual path than that which was, so obviously, failing to establish order. Anglicans called this path the “via media” or “Middle Way.” However, Platonists saw their reason as navigating through more dichotomies than just those between the different factions of Calvinists and Anglicans. They also sought to mediate between Faith and Science.

b. The Scientific Revolution

Sir Francis Bacon’s (1561–1626) development of the Scientific Method in Novum Organum (1620) produced empirical scientists who rejected the traditional Scholastic method of teaching, and sought to explain all phenomena in purely empirical, scientific terms. The Platonists were sympathetic to this agenda, despite Cambridge’s own institutional Scholasticism. Indeed, Ralph Cudworth, Henry More, and Joseph Glanville were all members of the Royal Academy, which was the social stronghold of the Baconian movement. But the Platonists were also aware of the potential that science could lead to Scientism, where science becomes an ideology, ignoring possible limits to its method, and treating it as the only way of discerning truth. This devalues all other ways of experiencing reality.

More specifically, they believed that following this scientific path without restraint led to Materialism, the belief that all things were made of matter, and Mechanism, which held that all actions could be explained in terms of interacting matter, like a line of dominoes, or interlocking gears. Together, these ideas implied determinism, although a form of determinism different from that of the Calvinists. What humans saw as choice, they deemed an unreliable self-perception. Also, contemporaries understood God and the Soul as immaterial entities. Thus, neither of them could exist in a Materialist system. So, to the Platonists, if not handled carefully, the scientific method would cause Atheism to triumph (Tulloch, especially pp. 1-20, 63-90, 181-230).

This concern was vindicated by Sir Thomas Hobbes (1588–1679). Hobbes argued for all these positions, most famously in Chapter Three of Leviathan (1651). In the eyes of the Platonists, this book made Hobbes a primary threat to rational Christianity. But they would not reject the intellectual self-confidence of the new Scientific Revolution, which had, to some extent, led to him. Here, also, the Platonists needed to find some sort of Middle Path.

c. René Descartes (1596–1650)

Descartes had an ambiguous status among the Platonists. Henry More studied and directly corresponded with Descartes in the final years of the mathematician’s life. Along with fellow Platonist John Smith, More worked to have Descartes taught at Cambridge. But each of the Platonists grew suspicious of some of the implications of this new philosophy (Ibid., especially pp. 10-15, 63-90, 130-150, 181-230).

For example, Descartes believed that only “Efficient Causation” existed. In other words, he believed that all events were caused by a push from past events, and not by either a pull towards some foreordained future, as in “Final Causation,” or a drive arising from within an object’s inner nature, as in “Formal Causation.” Unfortunately, to the Platonists, Formal and Final Causation were the only possible explanations of the universal order manifest in the Laws of Nature (Cudworth, TISU, I, p. 144-146). Thus, the Platonists saw Descartes’s scientific explanations as self-destructive. They rested upon a model of causality that undermined the very possibility of scientific explanations, in general.

Indeed, the implications of believing in only efficient causation were even greater and grimmer. To the Platonists, as was common in their day, it was common sense that the essential characteristic of “life” was the ability to initiate actions and not merely await external motivation. That which needed to be moved from without was dead. More said, “Life is a power that moves itself.” (More, Enchiridion Metaphysicum, Lib. I, cap. 2, p. 6). Cudworth wrote, “Life is a principle of self‑activity, or a power of acting from within itself” (Cudworth, TISU, I, Chapter 4, p. 147). And Conway agreed; “Every creature has life, and life is a power of acting from itself” (Conway, Principles, Chapter 5, p. 35). Eliminating all causation but efficient causation was, from their perspective, to reduce the universe to a corpse.

Descartes also explained God, Matter, and Mind as separate substances, so that God and Mind could not be bound by mechanism. But his way of doing this totally alienated the three substances from each other so that it seemed impossible that they should ever interact. How might God, in such a case, have created the Universe or human souls? How might a human mind’s choice instruct its body to move? How might the eye’s reception of light provide information to the mind? Also, Descartes argued that, having no souls, animals were mere mechanisms and had no real consciousness but were only mistakenly interpreted as having it. Might this not apply to Man as well? Mightn’t a student be satisfied with the mechanistic description of the universe simply stop there and follow a monistic atheism?

In the face of such implications, Cudworth said of Descartes’s theories that there was “an undiscerned tang of the mechanic atheism hanging about them” (Cudworth, TISU, III, p. 75). The Platonists saw Descartes’s support of rationalistic science and his effort to defend the existence of the soul through dualism as praiseworthy. But they also judged these efforts to be an ultimately dangerous, failed attempt to answer the problems of Materialism, Mechanism, Determinism, and Atheism.

d. Baruch de Spinoza (1632–1677)

Spinoza was a monist who saw God and Nature as the one substance, which acted according to deterministic cause and effect relationships. To him, everything that existed was a mere modality of this one substance. When we saw this substance producing other modes, including the eternal modes that define the laws of nature, we called it “God.” When it oversees the interaction of changing and temporal modes according to set laws, we call it “Nature.” To suppose that God and Nature were different entities was to make a classification error based on differing perspectives.

The human mind, to Spinoza, was merely a self-aware expression of the modes that were the human body. Its highest ethical calling is for the mind to grow in its consciousness of God/Nature. This was a form of developing self-awareness, working through the development of reason.

Spinoza also held that every event in nature was the product of natural order. And so, they are determined by the causal history of the universe, a manifestation of the character of its unique substance. Thus, neither God, nor Nature, nor any human had free will.

Finally, to Spinoza, there is no evil. It is an illusion generated by the limited perspective and understanding of humans. God, he indicated, saw no such thing.

The Platonists did not approve of any of this (Tulloch, especially pp. 15-20,70-80.140-150, 210-230). Ralph Cudworth criticized “Stratonical Materialism,” where Nature is seen as unintelligent but capable of initiating action, in the True System, written one year after Spinoza’s Ethics, calling it atheism “of the most refined and subtle sort” (Cudworth, TISU, I, p. 147). Many consider this to be a sideswipe at Spinoza, but he was not mentioned by name.

Henry More published two articles against Spinoza, by name, in Opera omnia. More’s concern was that they conflated God and Nature, threatening to explain God in scientific terms: “God is not Nature; nor is it lawful to take Nature for God. For those who confound God with Nature thrust God down into the order of natural causes….And thus, they transform God into a certain natural thing, determined by necessity (More, Enchiridion Metaphysicum, Lib. III, cap. 12).

Anne Conway would later make her own challenge to Spinoza in her book, The Principles. There, she stresses that a being that has no volition cannot be good, and thus no one, not even God, can be good, according to Spinoza, and where there is no goodness, there can be no improvement, or moral transformation (Conway, Principles, Chapter 8, §§1-7, pp. 53-58). Neither can one be held responsible for anything (Ibid., Chapter 9, §§1-3, pp. 59-62), nor be loved for any reason (Ibid., Chapter 7, §§5-7, pp. 52-53). Also, his theory directly opposed all living experience (Ibid., Chapter 4, §§1-7, pp. 29-34).

To the Platonists, Spinoza was attempting to resolve the dichotomy of Theology and Science by expressing theological matters in terms of science. The result of this effort was, to them, the loss of any sense of legitimacy to religion itself. The resolution of the two perspectives dissolved the one they thought most vital and fundamental. As an alternative, the Platonists would seek to do the reverse and explain Science in terms of Theology, which would come down to explaining Matter in terms of Spirit. In other words, the Platonists were Idealists—a century before the movement officially began in Germany.

e. “Plato”

The Platonists’ collective understanding of Plato was very different from the contemporary consensus. Their editions of Plato were published by the New Platonic Academy of Florence, founded by Marsilio Ficino (1433–1499), and Ficino interpreted Plato through the perspective of what he called the “prisca theologia,” or “ancient theology.” Ficino and the Florentine Platonists sought to reconcile the philosophy of Greek antiquity, medieval Muslim falsafa, Hermeticism, and Kabbalism, with Renaissance Catholicism. They did this by depicting them all as different stages of one continuing intellectual project that was focused on reviving a pure faith that was known at the beginning of history and occasionally revived in later eras when it had gone too far astray. Within this movement, it was common to believe that Plato was inspired by Jewish works, possibly through the mediation of Pythagoras. Ficino interpreted Plato’s dialogues as introductory texts for a “secret doctrine” that was discussed privately at the Academy. This doctrine would later, he concluded, be Christianized by such later thinkers as Pseudo-Dionysus, Origen, and Augustine.

This was the “Platonism” of the Cambridge Platonists (Tulloch, especially pp.1-10, 63-80, 121-230). Much of Ralph Cudworth’s magnum opus, The True Intellectual System of the Universe, consisted of a wholesale attempt to rewrite the history of philosophy (really, mythologizing it) to show that it was all devoted, consciously or not, to the development of the “prisca theologia.” In one memorable section, Cudworth attributed the initial development of atomic theory to Moses, and this to divine revelation. He lamented that it would then be bowdlerized into an atheism by Democritus (Cudworth, TISU, I, pp. 118-119).

This commitment to the prisca theologia was not universal at Cambridge. Nathaniel Culverwell doubted the entire project. To him, there were basic truths available to all intellectual beings through their own experiences and efforts. And so, some ideas were bound to be rediscovered independently over the course of history (Culverwell, Discourse, pp. 10-14). But he seems to have been an outlier.

It would not be until the work of Friedrich Schleiermacher (1741–1810) that the work of Plato was generally studied as a distinct phenomenon, to be understood on its own terms. When this happened, the term “Neoplatonism” was coined to distinguish Plato from Plotinus and his successors. But this occurred long after all the Platonists had died, and they did not benefit from the insight. So, in contemporary terms, the Cambridge Platonists may be understood as a part of the Neoplatonic tradition, who believed, due to the historiographic limitations of their century, that they were following in the tradition of Plato.

2. Significant Cambridge Platonists

a. Benjamin Whichcote (1609–1683)

Benjamin Whichcote was the first of the Platonists. He enrolled at Emmanuel College, Cambridge, in 1628, and became a Fellow in 1633. On March 5, 1637, he was simultaneously named a deacon, a priest, and Sunday Afternoon Lecturer of Trinity Church, where he would give four sermons each Sunday, and one on Wednesdays. He would hold a Bachelor’s of Arts (1631), a Master’s of Arts (1634), a Bachelor’s of Divinity(1643), and a Doctorate of Divinity (1660).

In 1644, the Calvinist Parliament took control of all British Universities. He was then assigned the role of Provost of King’s College, despite the fact that Whichcote had not signed the National Covenant, opposing Charles the First’s attempted reform of the Church of Scotland. Upon the death of King Charles and the Calvinist takeover of England (1649), Whichcote was named vice-chancellor of Cambridge. He was temporarily removed from his position with the Restoration of the Monarchy (1660), but returned there in 1662.

Most of Whichcote’s writings come in the form of sermons and aphorisms. They were published posthumously by Anthony Cooper, the 3rd Earl of Shaftsbury. However, in 1651, Whichcote participated in an eight-letter-long correspondence where his old tutor Anthony Tuckney, over several mistakes of doctrine that Tuckney saw in Whichcote. Tuckney was one of the authors of the Westminster Confession of Faith (1643–48), which was the summation of the Reformed Church’s doctrine, at least in England. And so, he was a qualified representative and eager defender of Calvinism. In retrospect, this exchange has come to be seen as seminal to the development of Cambridge Platonism, expressing many of the group’s common foundational beliefs, thus establishing him as the first of the group.

Tuckney’s objections included the belief that Whichcote was too invested in the powers of human reason, setting it over divine revelation. Tuckney also thought Whichcote was optimistic concerning basic human nature, which was evidenced by Whichcote giving respect to ancient historical figures such as Plato and Aristotle, who were obviously not Jews or Christians and therefore had no prophetic authority. This, of course, also implied that current non-Christians could be laudable and available to moral and intellectual admiration, and emulation, which also implied the need for religious toleration. It seemed to Tuckney that there was a form of syncretism in Whichcote’s sermons where “A Platonique faith unites to God” (Whichcote & Tuckney, p. 39). Tuckney also thought that Cudworth implied that moral concerns trumped doctrinal decrees, a danger that was magnified by Cudworth’s evident belief that ethical judgements were based upon human reason and not on Divine Command. In summation, he complained that Whichcote trusted his own judgement and had developed and expressed too many new ideas to be theologically safe.

Whichcote attempted to defend himself from these charges with characteristic humility. He tried to depict his beliefs as being wholly within the bounds of Calvinism. But, in retrospect, those who would follow in his intellectual path would indeed take their ideas far from the doctrines of Calvinism, at least as far as Tuckney seems to have defined it.

b. Ralph Cudworth (1617-1688)

Ralph Cudworth enrolled in Emmanuel College, Cambridge, in 1630, and became a Fellow with a Master’s in 1639. He was elected Regis Professor of Hebrew in 1645. In the next year, he was awarded a Bachelor of Divinity and was invited to preach a sermon before the House of Commons. He was named Master of Claire Hall in 1650 and gained a Doctor of Divinity the next year. In 1654, after Henry More turned down the position, Cudworth was admitted as the Master of Claire College, a post he would retain for the rest of his life, even though he had given a sermon before the Long Parliament in 1647. He received a Doctorate of Divinity in 1651.

Cudworth’s philosophical works were The True Intellectual System of the Universe (1678), A Treatise Concerning Eternal and Immutable Morality (1731), and A Treatise on Freewill (1848). Together, they constitute the most complete available exposition of the Platonist worldview. His goals were to prove, in the face of the challenge that Thomas Hobbes represented, that God exists, that Free Will exists, and that morality was determinable by human Reason.

This project became controversial. Several Platonist doctrines inspired objections from either side of his middle path. Also, Cudworth’s writing style was self-sabotaging. He sought to systematically dismantle all opposing theories. To do this, he would, like St. Thomas Aquinas, begin by listing all of their arguments in a clear and rational form, and then disprove them all, step by step. However, Cudworth’s arguments against these positions never seemed as logical or as persuasive as those initial ones he said he wished to oppose. Some contemporary readers concluded that this was a tactic by a crypto-atheist to subtly corrupt the mind of the reader. Cudworth would eventually consider publishing his work on ethics at some point later, but set it aside when he discovered that his friend More was planning to produce a text on the subject, and he did not wish to compete for the audience or seem redundant. For these reasons, A Treatise Concerning Eternal and Immutable Morality and A Treatise on Freewill would be published posthumously.

c. Henry More (1614–1687)

Henry More enrolled at Christ’s College, Cambridge, in 1631. He achieved his Master’s in 1639 and became a Fellow in 1641. He would remain a fixture of Christ’s College for the rest of his life. He received a Doctor of Divinity in 1660.

More was the most prolific of the Platonist writers. He rebelled from deterministic Calvinism at an early age, but he remained the most mystical of the Platonists. This may be judged as an element of the Enthusiastic strain of English thought, trusting divine inspiration to guide his research. But More was aware of the dangers of this approach. And so, he insisted upon disciplining this inspiration with a strict rationalism to avoid what he saw as the extremism of the Calvinists, and later of the Quakers, who somewhat troubled him as they were going what he thought was just a bit too far into mysticism.

Another aspect of his ongoing search for truth was his great correspondence. He would exchange letters with Descartes, Thomas Hobbes, Robert Boyle, Joseph Glanville, George Keith, and Anne Conway. And he would remain in touch with several of the Quaker leaders of his day.

More’s writings are shorter and were published much more frequently than Cudworth’s. Sometimes, earlier in his career, he wrote them in verse. In those early writings, he would first discuss the old Neoplatonist doctrine that there existed an immaterial World Soul that he called “The Spirit of Nature,” an idea to which he became quite attached. His next publications were a pair of diatribes published under the pseudonym “Alazonomastix Philalethes.” They were focused on the alchemist Thomas Vaughan, who argued for the existence of the World Soul, but implied that it was a material entity.

By the 1650’s, More entered into a more settled intellectual middle age, expressing his set doctrine in four works: An Antidote Against Atheism (1653), Conjectura Cabbalistica: Or, A Conjectural Essay of Interpreting the Mind of Moses According to a Threefold Cabbala, Viz., Literal, Philosophical, Mystical, or Divinely Moral (1653), Enthusiasmus Triumphatus (1656), and The Immortality of the Soul (1659). Upon the Restoration of the Monarchy and the fall of Calvinist government, he turned away from philosophy to write on theology and focused on criticizing the flaws of Calvinism, insisting that he never really was a Calvinist due to his belief in Free Will.

Eventually, More collected all his works and translated them into Latin for more general publication as Opera omnia (1675–1679). He published two other works in Latin, Enchiridion Ethicum (1667) and Enchiridion Metaphysicum (1671). These allowed for a more general Continental audience for his ideas and those of the Platonists in general.

d. Peter Sterry (1613–1672)

Peter Sterry enrolled at Emmanuel in 1629, was a student of Whichcote, and after achieving his Bachelor of Arts in 1633, received his Master of the Arts degree, and was elected a fellow of Emmanuel in 1636, though he did not stay there long. He served as chaplain to Robert Greville and Oliver Cromwell and is listed as delivering sermons to Parliament in 1649, 1651, and 1656. After the Restoration, he retired to a suburb of London but continued to perform sermons, although they were not popular due to his tendency to use several unexplained allusions in them. His works reveal a figure interested in studying and criticizing the works of Plato and Origen. He was also an early supporter of Quakerism. Sterry’s only philosophical work was his posthumously published A Discourse of the Freedom of the Will (1675).

e. John Smith (1618–1652)

John Smith was the sickly child of poor and obscure parents who were able to enroll in Emmanuel in 1636 due to the intervention of wealthier patrons. There, Whichcote became his tutor and friend. He achieved his Bachelor of Arts in 1640 and his Master of Arts in 1644. Unfortunately, he did not become a fellow of the college because Emmanuel only allowed for one Fellow to come from each county. However, he was, in 1644, named a Fellow of Queen’s College, and given a post there teaching Hebrew, Greek, and Mathematics, as well as being the local Philosophic Censor. He was given a turn serving in the rotating one-year appointment of Dean and Catechist in 1650. During this time, he delivered six of the ten sermons that would posthumously be collected and published as Select Discourses (1660). They are primarily expressions and extensions of Whichcote’s ideas. Upon the conclusion of that year, he rapidly succumbed to the poor health that had plagued him all his life.

f. Nathaniel Culverwell (1619–1651)

Nathaniel Culverwell was the author of the first Cambridge Platonist work to be published: An Elegant and Learned Discourse of the Light of Nature (1652). It was an effort to import Natural Law theory into the dispute between Calvinism and Orthodox Anglicanism. Culverwell there focused on freedom of the will, and supported a rationalist epistemology based upon innate ideas and reason, instead of involving empirical experience. He received a Bachelor of Arts in 1641 and a Master of Arts in 1645, and he was elected a fellow of Emmanuel in the same year.

g. Joseph Glanville (1636 –1680)

Joseph Glanville was a philosopher, clergyman, and passionate champion of science and the scientific method. He was raised as a strict Puritan and educated at Oxford, receiving a Bachelor of Arts in 1655 and a Master of Arts in 1658. He received a Doctorate in Divinity in 1678 by royal decree.

As to his career, he was elected vicar of Frome in 1662, was the rector of the Abbey of Bath from 1666 to 1680, and prebendary of Worcester from 1678 until his death in 1680. His identification as a Cambridge Platonist is uncertain. But he is included for the sake of thoroughness. He certainly associated with them socially and wrote with them in favor of reason and religious tolerance.

More introduced Glanville to the philosophy of Descartes, and Glanville responded with his book Scepsis Scientifica (1665), where he introduced a more moderate form of Descartes’s method of doubt. On the strength of this book, he was elected a Fellow of the Royal Society. He would spend the rest of his life as a champion of science, praising it for producing practical aids to the common man, and calling for it to be explained to the general population in simple, common-sensical prose, available to all through the media available to him.

While he was primarily associated with Oxford, Glanville was contemporarily called “a Latitude Man” for his stress on the need for a “middle way” in his sermons. His first publication, The Vanity of Dogmatism (1661), was a long plea for religious and intellectual tolerance. In Essays on Several Important Subjects in Philosophy and Religion (1676), he attacked Enthusiasm and the mysticism of religious dissenters in favor of reason. In this collection, he would also publish A Continuation of the New Atlantis, an attempted sequel to Bacon’s Utopia where he took a set of scholars—thinly veiled representations of the Cambridge Platonists—to the island kingdom, having fled the tumult of Britain.

In 1665, Glanville and Henry More participated in a house party at Ragley Hall, hosted by Lady Anne Conway, where they discussed a report of poltergeist activity. This seemed to spark some interest in him, and he would eventually write his Blow at Modern Sadducism (1668), a text justifying witch hunts. More would posthumously publish Glanville’s expansion of this book, Saducismus Triumphatus (1681). Cotton Mather would consult this text to help justify the hunt for witches in Salem, in his famous book Wonders of the Invisible World (1673). Ironically, this seems to be the work for which this “Latitude Man” retains his greatest current fame.

h. Anne Finch Conway, Viscountess Conway (1631–1679)

Anne Finch Conway grew up in her family residence, now known as Kensington Palace, the youngest child of the Speaker of the House of Commons. She was taught Latin, Greek, and Hebrew while growing up, and her half-brother John Finch encouraged her study of both philosophy and theology. He also introduced her to Henry More, who had been his tutor at Christ’s College. She would then informally study philosophy under More through correspondence. Her eventual husband, Viscount Edward Conway, had also been a student of More’s, and he encouraged their friendship.

Upon her wedding in 1651, she made her home, Ragley Hall, in Warwickshire, already possessed of one of the biggest private libraries in England, into a think-tank that was visited, and sometimes lived in, on a semi-permanent basis, by such figures as the physician Francis Mercury van Helmont, who also treated her for her migraines, George Fox, who founded the Quakers, Robert Barclay, maybe the most famous writer among the Quakers of his day, William Penn, who was both a Quaker and the eventual founder of the colony of Pennsylvania, and Gottfried Wilhelm Leibniz, mathematician and philosopher. More, himself, was frequently her guest, as well. In 1653, he dedicated his book, An Antidote to Atheism, to her. During the last ten years of her life, she studied the Kabala and converted to Quakerism.

Conway would write her only book, The Principles of the Most Ancient and Modern Philosophy in English, in 1677. It was posthumously published anonymously, as was considered necessary for a woman, at the time, in Latin in 1690, and translated back to English for republication in 1692. That last edition survives with several anonymous annotations, not in Conway’s original text, that are remarkable for including the first published use of the term “monad.”

i. Damaris Cudworth Masham, Lady Masham (1659–1708)

Lady Masham was the daughter of Ralph Cudworth and was raised in a Platonist environment with access to his library. Her first correspondence with John Locke was romantic, but by the time of Locke’s self-exile in Holland (1683–89), they graduated to more intellectual concerns. Upon his return, Locke would live at the Masham estate at Oats. She wrote two books, A Discourse Concerning the Love of God (1696) and Occasional Thoughts in Reference to a Virtuous or Christian Life (1705). Both were, of course, published anonymously.

Masham’s books were primarily concerned with ethics and theology. In them, she was very much in agreement with her father and the Platonists. She stressed free will, the eternality of ethical standards, and rejected Calvinist voluntarism, while encouraging religious tolerance. In her final book, Occasional Thoughts, she would provide a summary of the Platonist belief in the relationship of religion with reason. She began with the Platonist thesis that religion is a means of bringing man into a proper relationship with God. Then, she moved on to say that this was done through moral education. But, to her, as with the other Platonists, all ethics were implied by innate rationality. So, an ethical study required a more general rational education. She then finished with a new idea: that this implied that women should be given full access to education. Otherwise, she concluded, no woman would be capable of providing children with a proper moral upbringing.

Locke would spend his final years at Oates. She would then meet his intellectual circle, which included Anthony Ashly Cooper, Third Earl of Shaftsbury, and Sir Isaac Newton. On the international level, she would exchange letters with Jean Le Clerc and Gottfried Leibniz, among others. Her correspondence shows that she exposed Locke to her father’s work and defended that of his fellow Platonist John Smith. She also discussed with Leibniz the similarities between her father’s conception of Plastic Nature and Leibniz’s own Theory of Pre-established Harmony. LeClerc would write a review of her Discourse in Bibliotheque Choisie.

3. Central Beliefs of the Cambridge Platonists

a. Tolerance

To Anthony Tuckney, one of the most dangerous of the Platonists’ beliefs was that they thought that Christian thinkers needed to be tolerant of alternative belief systems. According to Tuckney, Whichcote claimed that there are some questions beyond the ability of reasonable and religious people to solve, about which one must be tolerant. Whichcote replied with religious humility, saying, “I cannot think it safe to bind men to words which Scripture bindeth not” (Whichcote & Tuckney, p. 52). Also, “I dare not go beyond what is written; nor impose upon others what I cannot prove” (Ibid., p. 53). And finally, “I would not make my private sense the measure of another man’s faith” (Ibid., p. 55).

This answer, of course, did not help at all, because it implied that Scripture, at least as humans could understand it, did not provide the answer to all questions. “I beleeve…” said Tuckney, “it would be very unsafe and unsound to say, that they are not certainly determined in the scriptures; but that they should seem, in some places or other, to countenance the two contrary parties” (Ibid., p. 23). To him, Scripture had to be understood as universal, univocal, indubitable, and, of course, as interpreted by his prophetic authority.

But such theological humility would become essential to the agenda of Whichcote’s admirers, the “Latitude Men.” In a time of intolerance, the Cambridge Platonists sought to be, quite literally, the Voice of Reason. Nothing could be further from reason than the inspired, passionate, authoritative pronouncements of the conflicting Enthusiast factions, which, at the time, were trying to cobble together a workable government from out of the factions that, having just overthrown their king, were already primed for further internal violence (Tulloch, pp. 8-18).

For other Platonists, this tolerance went farther than just being willing to debate with other Calvinists. They would hold that the redemptive work of Jesus was best understood as an ongoing repair and restoration of the innate rational and moral capacities of man. The religious element was necessary to this work, but it was a work focused on and using reason, not faith (Smith, Discourse 2, pp. 10-12, 25-35). Reason worked in partnership with an indwelling Holy Spirit. Without the active participation of both, humans would be unable to make real progress.

God naturally loves the good, so to seek ethical perfection, in any manner whatsoever, was to align oneself with God (Conway, Principles, IX). And so, all religions should be understood as a means towards the end of a closer relationship with God, instead of causes unto themselves. “True religion is not confined to this or that sect but is spread abroad in the hearts of all that sincerely love God and their neighbour” (More, Explanation, II, p. 210). This relationship would be achieved through the moral reformation of man.

And so, when Ralph Cudworth was invited to provide a sermon before the Long Parliament on the 31 of May 1674, it was over the need for religious tolerance. A month later, Whichcote said to the same body, “We must carry ourselves with meekness and gentleness towards those that differ from us” (Whichcote, Sermon, EEBO image 7, sig. A3r). None of the Platonists were present in 1655, when Oliver Cromwell assembled the Whitehall Conference concerning the possible readmission of the Jews to England, but their writings were influential.

But none of this should be taken as a sign that any faith was above their reasoned criticism. In addition to the Calvinists, they also criticized the Calvinists’ main theological rivals in England, the more orthodox Anglicans, led by William Laud, the Archbishop of Canterbury. As perfect Reason was the essential feature of God, and thus of Man’s relationship with God, organized religion, dogma, church government, and rituals were all unneeded, as long as one focused upon learning and improving one’s rational understanding of ethics. Whichcote summed the Platonist position when he said, “To go against reason is to go against God.…Reason is the Divine governor of Man’s life; it is the very voice of God” (Whichcote, Aphorisms, p. 76).

b. The Supremacy of Reason

In order for reason to have any role in the disputes in doctrine, it had to have authority over faith. This was another grievous error in the mind of Tuckney. Tuckney wrote “Whilest you were (a) fellow here… some … studyed other authors, more than the scriptures; and Plato and his schollars, above others… hence in part hath runne a veine of doctrine… Reason hath too much given to it” (Whichcote & Tuckney, p. 38 ). And so, it metastasized to such a state that “…our faith should be ultimately resolved in rationem rei, ex parte objecti; [the reason of the thing in-itself] and that ratio humana should be summus judex, ex parte subjecti [human reason should be the final judge on the subject] …. I think it very strange divinity” (Ibid., p. 20). Tuckney rejected such thoughts as this, saying it “proves nauseous” (Ibid., p. 5).

Cudworth replied that “Reason is the Candle of the Lord set up in us” (Ibid., p. 48). This paraphrase of Proverbs 20:27 would prove to be a general creed for the Platonists. He later added that “Reason is the highest faculty in man, and the nearest to God” (Ibid., p. 56), and that “They that lay aside Reason, to pretend the Spirit, are in danger to lose both” (Ibid., p. 52). The two were not in conflict in his mind. “I do not set Reason against Faith; but I say, Faith is a reasonable act” (Ibid.).

The Platonists, in general, rejected the Calvinist conception of the Deity, with omnipotence trumping logic, so that God existed and acted for no comprehensible reason or motive. They instead subordinated God’s omnipotence to His omniscience. Thus, logic as an aspect of His own perfect character was even God’s master. As Culverwell put it: “’tis expresse blasphemy to say that either God, or the Word of God did ever, or ever will, oppose Right Reason” (Culverwell, Discourse of the Light of Nature, I, p. 24).

c. Innate Ideas, Essences, Powers, and the Seeds of Eternity

This focus on reason demanded some consideration of the nature of reason and of the ideas about which we reasoned. To Cudworth, purely material senses could not produce information without some form of translation of the data to a new medium. He foreshadows Kant, saying “Sense itself takes no cognizance of any such things… it only receives the impressions of figure and colour. The mind therefore must needs exert its own activity in forming the conceptions which arise thereupon” (Cudworth, TCEIM, p. 20). But these innate powers are not like Descartes’s innate ideas. To Cudworth, Descartes’s model of the mind is a mere “mechanical philosophy of the mind” (Ibid.).

Instead, Cudworth believed that the mind of Man operated analogously to the mind of God. God’s eternal rationality implied that there were objects of reason available to God before He acted, and there had to be at least one: God Himself, and the workings of His mind, which provided certain ideas and logic that structured His thought (Whichcote, Discourses, VI, p. 88). Cudworth would call these divine ideas the “Essences,” effectively the Cambridge version of the Platonic Forms (Cudworth, TISU, I, p. 147), as they were understood by Plotinus. All of God’s thoughts, actions, and creations would be subordinate to their logic (Cudworth, TCEIM, pp. 19-22).

Humans are self-aware. So, we would have the same power of introspection. Through this introspection, we would also be able to determine these logical principles and implied Essences by considering the order of their own thoughts and of nature. Thus, in place of innate ideas, Cudworth believed that human minds should be understood as having innate powers to construct certain ideas, the “Noemata” based on our apprehensions of reason within ourselves (TISU, III, pp. 66-70).

More agreed with Cudworth for the most part, insisting that “The mind is not a naked capacity to receive ideas, but an active, self-moving principle” (More, EM, p. 291). But More’s analog for innate ideas was, perhaps, a bit more sympathetic to Descartes than Cudworth’s. To him, the human mind contained “certain inward anticipations and seminal principles of knowledge” (Ibid. p. 243-4). This image of seeds appealed to Smith; he wrote of “Seeds of eternity” planted in the human mind by God (Smith, pp. 10-11). Culverwell began An Elegant and Learned Discourse of the Light of Nature, saying “The principles of natural light are clear and indubitable, shining in the minds of men” (Culverwell, p. 5). And Conway would write “The creature hath from God a power of knowing, loving, and acting” (Conway, 1. § 7, p. 15).

So, all the Platonists believed that knowledge was generated by the human mind through intellectual, introspective effort. They would never depict the mind as a passive recipient of data from any source, whether it was God or experience (Cudworth, TISU, II, p. 99). This potential knowledge was innate to the human mind, but in the form of powers awaiting to be used (Cudworth, TCEIM, p. 41; Smith, Discourses, II, p. 145; More, An Explanation, I, p. 58). They were never present as passive entities waiting to be discovered.

Plato’s Theory of Recollection, ironically, proved to be of no help for this problem whatsoever to the Platonists. The Cambridge School rejected reincarnation. More would try to protect Plato’s reputation from criticism by saying that he had merely been speaking from poetic metaphor, when he was expressing the Theory, and that he was, despite the evidence of his written words, in complete agreement with More and the other Platonists (More, ET, p. 12).

d. Rational Ethics

The Platonists’ rejection of Voluntarism led them towards the Rationalist solution to the Euthyphro dilemma: that God loved certain actions and characteristics because they already had some property or properties that inspired that love. More objected to Descartes’s conception of innate ideas on the grounds that, because Descartes was a Voluntarist, his theory of innate ideas, inscribed on the human mind by God, left us bereft when seeking an objective and rational standard of right and wrong (More, AA, III, p. 12). In More’s own words, “God’s omnipotence is bounded by His own nature, which is wisdom and goodness itself” (More, Explanation, I, p. 72). Humans that can perceive these properties might then deduce that they were moral and thus loved by God independently of any consultation with the Deity. And so, the Platonists pointed to humanity’s facility for reason as proof that it was still capable of some degree of goodness through its own efforts (Smith, Select Discourses, III, p. 145). Original Sin merely damaged the human capacity for reason and morality. It did not destroy it, as the Calvinists believed (More, Explanation, Book I, p. 42).

Tuckney, of course, objected to this whole idea, saying that in Whichcote’s work “The power of Nature, in Morals, too much advanced” (Tuckney & Whichcote, p. 38). That Whichcote “spoke too much of the powers of nature, and too little of the corruption of it” (Tuckney and Whichcote, I, p. 10). That in Whichcote’s sermons, “A kinde of a Moral Divinitie minted; onlie with a little tincture of Christ added…. And Inherent righteousnesse so preached, as if not with the prejudice of imputed righteousness… yet much said of the one, and very little or nothing of the other” (Ibid., p. 39). Such things did not meet with his understanding of human nature: “I cannot go with you in so fair a report of man” (Ibid., p. 11). Whichcote pleaded that he was following Paul in his beliefs: “These phrases of the Apostle… have forced upon me all those notions I do entertain, or have publiquely delivered, concerning natural light, or the use of reason” (Ibid., p. 12).

e. Free Will

Armed with these ideas, the Platonists’ response to the problem of Free Will vs. Determinism was to develop a form of Soft Determinism. Cudworth anticipated Locke in arguing that it is not the Will, but the Agent that is best described as “free” (Cudworth, TFW, pp. 24-25). Reason and Will are both modalities of a single entity, the Mind. Thus, choice must be understood as conjoined with the rational understanding that guides choice. People do what seems good to them because their Reason tells them that it is good. As More wrote: “True liberty is not a power of doing evil, but a power of acting according to right reason.” (More, Grand Mystery, p. 72).

Ethical deliberation was epistemological, not an example of arbitrary action, nor of conditioned reflexes. And so, human will is free from constraint to the extent that human reason is free to determine what is good. The innate operations of the mind empower this freedom. When it behaves correctly in accordance with human rational character, it is free. Any failure to do good was because of a failure of the intellect to correctly determine what was good. To Platonists, free will consisted of the ability of human reason to determine Good and Evil through its own efforts.

f. Ontology, esp. Cudworth, More, and Conway

Cudworth’s initial ambition for the True System was to discuss free will and determinism in opposition to Hobbes. But he found this issue imported so many ideas from Ontology, Epistemology, and Ethics that he had to clear away the confusion in these areas before he could begin. His goal for Ontology and Epistemology would be to allow for scientific advancements of the day without succumbing to Atheism or Determinism. This would be the topic of The True Intellectual System of the Universe.

Cudworth began with Atomism, a belief he respected, but found incomplete. He claimed that any atomist must also be a dualist because material atoms were essentially passive and could not initiate action (TISU, Vol. I, pp. 142-145; 147-50). To explain activity, therefore, there must be something immaterial that was essentially active to begin action. Cudworth’s dualism necessarily inspired in him a great interest in Descartes; however, Descartes had taken extreme steps to completely divorce the two substances. Cudworth saw it as necessary that there be a “Third Man” mediating between God, Soul, and Matter.

To Cudworth, this mediator was “Plastic Nature” (Cudworth, TISU, I, pp. 170-5). It was “reason immersed and plunged into matter, mind and body, as it were, fuddled in it and confounded in it….” (Cudworth, Treatise on Free Will, pp. 20-21). It moved in accordance with the logical order described by the Essences, which were the innate ideas existing in the mind of God, defining His logic and thus Reality. Plastic Nature pushed matter about in a manner that provided for the regular rational order of natural behavior and “makes several actions conspire to one end” (Cudworth, TISU, I, p. 260). It maintained the universe on what we might call automatic pilot, preserving God from having to “as it were, with His own hands form the body of every gnat” (Cudworth, TISU, I, pp. 243). But as it is a vital, spiritual force, it does so without turning the cosmos into a mechanism.

Plastic Nature, while spiritual, would be unconscious. As a result, it would not be capable of making situational judgements. Direct intervention from God would be needed when exceptions were required. This would be where the miraculous could be found (Cudworth, TISU, I, pp. 14-16). Otherwise, the continual action of this Plastic Nature provided the universe with the Formal and Final causation that Descartes claimed did not exist.

Cudworth also believed that Plastic Nature was at work in the human mind. He said that there is a “more interior kind of plastic power to the soul, whereby it is formative of its own cognitions, which itself is not always conscious of” (Cudworth, TISU, I, p. 247). In other words, Plastic Nature accounted for the unconscious mind of a human.

More’s response to the problem of mechanism was very much like Cudworth’s. He posited that an unconscious Neoplatonic emanation of God, “The Spirit of Nature,” which served as a secondary cause for physical actions (More, IoS, III, Chapters 12-14). Initially, More would not clearly express how it did this. Instead, he experimented with various possibilities over the course of his writing. Sometimes, he would attribute specific powers to the Spirit. On other occasions, he wrote that it would communicate the Laws of Nature to Matter. Still later, he would describe how it united with each independent bit of matter to propel them. But the role of the Spirit would grow more predominant in More’s mind as he matured. Eventually, he would reach the conclusion that any bit of matter untouched by this Spirit would immediately become motionless, so that even motion that we would say was the product of inertia from some previous source was really a manifestation of Spirit. In other words, More believed that there was no purely mechanical action or reaction in the universe. The Spirit of Nature explained all motion, as well as natural phenomena beyond Mechanism, such as life, gravity, and cohesion (Ibid.).

More would also conclude that extension in space and time was an essential characteristic of existing things in general, not just of matter. Existence always implied, to More, that one existed somewhere and at some time [More, IoS, II. Chapters 12 and 13; Antidote, III, Chapters 13-14; EM, Chapters 5-7 (especially Chapter 6); Dialogues, II]. So, to More, space and time were absolute. Souls and other spirits had size and location. God, as infinite, took up an infinity of space, and all other bits of matter existed within that space, interpenetrated by God. In the same passages, he applies this same idea to time. God, as eternal, exists in an infinity of time. Events occur within this domain. Simply by being, God is the topographical foundation of the universe, and the absolute backdrop for all events (Reid, 2007).

In another rejection of Descartes, More also insisted that animals had consciousness. He saw the Cartesian belief that animals were only automata as too short a step away from the claim that humans were also, and that all our behaviors also might be explained by material phenomena. So, he leapt in the opposite direction, claiming that matter was essentially passive, and that all “living” entities that could initiate motion, plants, animals, or men had to possess an immaterial component. (More, Antidote, III, Chapters 1-3).

Ann Conway, in The Principles of the Most Ancient and Modern Philosophy, made it clear that she found any dualism, whether that of Descartes or of her fellow Platonists, to be incoherent because it was unable to explain persuasively how matter and spirit could interact. While More and Cudworth sought to prove spirit existed alongside matter, Conway thought that matter and spirit are simply two ends of a single, living spectrum. She turned to monism, the only one among the Platonists, concluding that “the whole creation is just but one substance or entity.” exhibiting “a general unity of creatures with one another” (Conway, Principles, VII, p. 4) and that “body is nothing but fixed and condensed spirit; and spirit is nothing but volatile body or body made subtle” (Conway, Principles, VIII, p. 4).

At the same time, Conway rejected Spinoza’s monism for implying that demons and evil were potentially manifestations of God (Conway, Principles, IX). Her alternative was “individuation,” a Neoplatonic belief that the universe was a spectrum of emanations from an eternal, perfect, and wholly spiritual God, with each emanation being an inferior copy of its preceding manifestation. Thus, unfavored qualities and beings could be rejected as errors caused by their being the copy of a copy, existing in the inferior medium of space/time (Conway, Principles, VIII).

She called distinctions between different manifestations of Spirit “species.” It helped to set her apart from Spinoza’s “modes.” The differences between each of these species were purely modal and marked by the different availabilities of each one to change, due to their growing vulnerability to space and time. God was eternal, which is to say He did not exist in space and time, and so, as a species, He was perfect and unchanging. Matter, the lowest of the species, existed wholly in space and time and, as a result, was flawed and in constant flux.

Following Origen, Conway set a third species, “Christ,” between God and Matter, providing mediation in a manner directly analogous to Plastic Nature, or More’s Spirit of Nature (Conway, Principles, VII). It operated in space and time but was also in direct contact with the eternal character of God. Thus, it could initiate change in other objects, but these changes may only constitute improvements (Ibid.).

4. The Influences of the Cambridge Platonists on Others

a. John Locke (1632–1704)

Locke was not a Platonist. He had several clear differences with Platonism. For example, he was a Voluntarist. And he believed that ethics was, to some extent, a human construct through the Social Contract, not a product of an innate rational benevolence in human character.

Locke is also famous for his attack upon the belief in innate ideas. It is possible that this criticism of the idea was directly aimed at the Platonists (Armstrong, p. 191). If this is so, it is not to Locke’s credit. In his Essay on Human Understanding, Locke said of innate ideas that “(i)t is an established opinion amongst some men, that there are in the understanding certain innate principles… characters stamped upon the mind of man” (Locke, Essay, Book I, 2.1). And that “(i)f they are innate, they must needs have been in the understanding before it was capable of any thought” (Ibid., Book I, 2.5). But “(i)t is said, the principles of morality are innate… but I cannot find any moral rule which can pretend to universal assent.” And finally, “(i)f they were innate, they should be universally known… but there are none to which all mankind give an universal assent.” (Ibid., Book I, 2.3)

None of these objections applies to the epistemology of the Cambridge Platonists. They directly opposed Descartes’ belief that the human mind had direct access to ideas somehow recorded upon it by God. Instead, they believed that God empowered the mind with the ability and the disposition to develop these ideas through its own efforts. Given that some might not use these powers, and that each might develop these ideas at their own pace, it would not be surprising if there was no “universal assent” concerning any of them. If the Platonists were the targets of this criticism, then Locke was attacking a Straw Man.

On the other hand, Locke met both Cudworth and his daughter Damaris, later Damaris Masham, in London. He would remain close to Damaris for the rest of his life. We also know, through their surviving correspondence, that Masham reviewed and criticized Locke’s article “On Power,” and Locke was living at her Oakes estate while he produced his third draft of the Essay on Human Understanding. Much of Locke’s argument on the existence of God (Locke, Essay, 4.10) is parallel with Cudworth’s True System. And, when arguing that it is the person that is free, not the will (Locke, Essay, 2.12.17), Locke uses arguments very similar to Cudworth’s (Cudworth, TFW, pp. 24-25).

b. Isaac Newton (1642–1747)

Isaac Newton, who was a friend of Locke’s, enrolled at Christ’s College in 1661, and he agreed with More’s idea of Absolute Space and expanded upon it with his greater grasp of mathematics and geometry. It is unknown to what extent More was responsible for this, but Newton’s copies of More’s works still exist beside other works by the Platonists in his library, well-thumbed and annotated by his own notes (Reid, 2022). Newton also speculated in his Opticks (1704) about the possible existence of a substance he called “Aether,” which has some properties and functions like “the Spirit of Nature.” (Joseph, 2016.) However, as Newton’s Aether was material and operated mechanically, not teleologically, this analogy may be deemed, by an unsympathetic reader, to be weak.

c. Samuel Clarke (1675–1729)

Samuel Clarke (1675–1729) was born in Norwich, England, and educated at Gonville and Caius College, Cambridge. Clarke’s association with the Cambridge Platonists, beside Cambridge, itself is primarily due to a footnote located in Section 3, Part 2 of David Hume’s Enquiry Concerning the General Principles of Morals (1751) where he comments of Rationalistic Ethics “Father Malebranche, as far as I can learn, was the first that started this abstract theory of morals, which was afterwards adopted by Cudworth, Clarke, and others; and as it excludes all sentiment, and pretends to found everything on reason, it has not wanted followers in this philosophic age” (Hume, Enquiry, pp. 209-10). Cudworth had written his Treatise Concerning Eternal and Immutable Morality before Malebranche’s ethical work, but it had not been published until 1731. But how correct was Hume in linking Cudworth’s ethics to Clarke’s?

Clarke definitely was sympathetic to many of Cudworth’s Platonist positions. In Clarke’s Boyle Lectures, he made it plain that ethics was, to his mind, as logical as mathematics, and based on self-evident axioms: Saying “eternal and necessary differences of things make it fit and reasonable for creatures so to act…even as it is fit and reasonable that twice two is four”(Clarke, Discourses, pp. 46-47). He also claimed that God was bound by the same axioms, saying “It is as truly and absolutely impossible for God not to do (or do anything contrary to what His moral attributes [such as Justice and Goodness] require him to do; as if he was necessitated by a natural and physical compulsion”(Ibid. p. 115). Thus, in regard to The Supremacy of Reason, Rational Ethics, and Free Will, he was in line with the Latitude Men.

He would have probably argued for religious tolerance as well, sharing Newton’s Non-trinitarian beliefs, and defending them in public debates. He was forced to publicly denounce this belief in 1724, but kept it privately all his life. Posthumously, his personal copy of the 1692 Book of Common Prayer was found to contain several alterations and corrections. This text was donated to the British Museum and became an inspiration for the Unitarian version of the Book of Common Prayer, still used today.

But there is a problem with attributing to Clarke the mantle of a later-day Platonist. Clarke served as a primary proponent of Newton’s Theory of Gravity in his generation. Cartesians objected to Newton’s theory in part because it supposed that space was a void and not filled by some sort of medium that could convey mechanical motion from one body to another, reducing gravity to what was called an “occult power,” meaning basically a deus ex machina thrown in arbitrarily to make the theory work. Clarke’s argument in response to the Cartesian objection was that gravity was the product of “God’s acting upon matter continually and every moment” (Ibid., p. 300)—the ultimate occult power. It did not involve any intermediate substance such as Plastic Nature or the World Soul.

In addition, in 1715 and 1716, he engaged in a five-letter correspondence with Leibniz, debating Newton’s theory, with some input from Newton himself. It was mediated and arbitrated by Leibniz’s student, Caroline, the Princess of Wales. There, Clarke objected to the Principle of Sufficient Reason by appealing to a kind of Voluntarism. He wrote “’Tis very true, that nothing is, without a sufficient Reason why it is… But this sufficient Reason is oft-times no other, than the mere Will of God” (Clarke, Collection, pp. 121). Moreover, he wrote elsewhere that “An agent, that is necessary, is a contradiction in terms; for that which is necessary, is not an agent, but is only acted upon” (Demonstration, p. 1).

This seems in direct contradiction to his claim that ethics are intellectually determined even by God. He tries to address this by saying: “For God to choose against his best judgment is ‘a contradiction in terms, morally speaking … But it is no contradiction in physicks’” (Clarke, Remarks, p. 716). So, it seems that he had no issue with the Principle of Sufficient Reason in ethics, but believed that no reason in physics was sufficient without miraculous intervention. He called this “the Principle of Indifference” (Collection, p. 121). This does not sound very Platonic.

d. Anthony Ashly Cooper, the 3rd Earl of Shaftesbury (1671–1713)

The Third Earl of Shaftesbury was John Locke’s student and a frequent guest at Masham’s Oates estate. His literary career began when he published the sermons of Benjamin Whichcote in two volumes, writing the preface to it himself. In that preface, one may see that Shaftsbury had, in fact, come to favor Whichcote over his mentor. He rejected Hobbesian determinism, egoistic ethics, and Locke in favor of moral realism. His own preference was the Platonist view that humans were naturally benevolent creatures due to their reasoning abilities. He published these thoughts in 1711, in the form of a three-volume anthology of papers written between 1705 and 1710, entitled Characteristicks of Men, Manners, Opinions, Times.

Central to Shaftsbury’s beliefs was the very Platonic idea that man’s chief occupation was moral evolution through intellectual self-development (Shaftesbury, Characteristicks, I. p. 93). Thus, he would reject metaphysics, epistemology, and science as being of no use. Instead, he focused on ethics and considered our emotions and psychological experience the foundations of ethics. But this did not cause him to reject the Platonist belief in reason as the root of ethics. To Shaftsbury, man develops his ethics by what he called “soliloquy,” a personal reflection on one’s immediate experiences. This produces an active, intellectual moral sense in response to aesthetic impressions of their moral character.

In other words, to Shaftsbury, the good was that which is intellectually beautiful. These standards would be innate to man, and indeed, to God. Shaftsbury, like Whichcote, and unlike Locke, rejected Voluntarism (Ibid., p. 2). To him, this aesthetic conception of the Good was based upon the perception that an act or event was in harmony with the unique entity that was the Universe. The clear forerunners of this belief might be the Stoics, but Shaftsbury’s teleological order of creation also reflects More and Cudworth.

e. Gottfried Leibniz (1646–1716)

Leibniz was aware of the Platonists. He was a regular guest of Lady Conway, and, in 1697, he wrote “my philosophical views approach somewhat closely those of the late countess Conway” (Schroeder, “Anne Conway’s Place: A Map of Leibniz,” p. 82). Leibniz had also read excerpts from the True System in 1689 and requested a copy of the entire book from Lady Masham in 1704. Leibniz wrote a letter of thanks to Lady Masham. This began a philosophical exchange that would last over the next two years.

The primary concern of their letters was “The Vitalist Controversy.” The encyclopedist Jean Le Clerc, a friend of Locke’s, translated long excerpts of Cudworth’s True Intellectual System, including Chapter Three, where Cudworth first described his concept of Plastic Nature, into French, and published them in Volume One of his encyclopedia, Bibliothèque choisie, between 1703 and 1706.

Pierre Bayle, a strong supporter of Cartesian philosophy, read these translations and objected that Cudworth’s Plastic Nature allowed causality to be explained by an unconscious agency. Bayle considered this to be a short step away from atheism, because if an unconscious agency was sufficient for ordering the universe, a conscious one would be redundant, leaving a Spinoza-like “Stratonical” Materialism. (Bayle, Dictionnaire historique et critique, I, pp. 761-769; “Examen du True Intellectual System of the Universe de M. Cudworth,” pp. 331-348.)

LeClerc recruited Gottfried Leibniz to join in the debate. He would eventually reply with “Considerations on Vital Principles and Plastic Natures, by the Author of the System of Pre-Established Harmony” (1705). The common verdict of both Masham and Leibnitz was that Bayle had underestimated the role that God played in Cudworth’s conception of Plastic Nature.

While discussing this debate, Masham and Leibniz also discussed the similarities between Plastic Nature and Leibniz’s Theory of Pre-Established Harmony. In the first letter, Leibnitz introduced this Theory to Masham, saying, “The subject also interests me greatly, for I have reflected deeply on this matter, and I even claim to have discovered a new region within this intelligible world, thereby expanding, if only slightly, the great system that your father has left us” (Leibniz, Philosophical Texts, p. 82). In “Considerations,” he would expand on this. While Leibnitz was willing to accept Cudworth’s conception of a mediation between the divine and inert matter to explain motion, he was unwilling to accept the thought of a universal force filling that role, when the pre-established harmony of each individual monad could do so (Leibniz, Philosophical Papers and Letters, pp. 586–587).

Lady Masham offered criticism that pressed Leibniz to a more sophisticated expression of his own arguments. Generally, she remained certain that while the theory was plausible, it was too dependent on speculation concerning man’s experience and powers of reason and was thus an unprofitable speculation. But she encouraged Leibniz to continue to publish his work.

f. Harvard, Yale, and Salem

Upon the fall of the Lord Protectorate, many Calvinist leaders found the New World to be a healthier climate. Among these leaders was Ralph Cudworth’s brother, James. Others included John Cotton, Thomas Hooker, the founder of Connecticut, and John Harvard, after whom Harvard University was to be named. All were alumni of Emmanuel College. Henry More’s Enchiridion Ethicum (1667) was enshrined as Harvard’s principal textbook on ethics in the 1680’s. Eventually, this would be taken up by Yale (Howe, 1988). As has been said before, Glanville’s posthumous Saducismus Triumphatus (1681) would also be quite influential in the area, providing guidance and justification for the witch trials of Salem in 1692.

g. Samuel Taylor Coleridge (1772–1834)

Samuel Taylor Coleridge is today best remembered as a founder of the English Romantic movement, but he was also a student of philosophy. From 1791 until 1794, Coleridge attended Jesus College at Cambridge, where he encountered radical political and theological ideas. It is logical to surmise that he encountered the ideas of the Cambridge Platonists at this time, as is evidenced by the tribute he paid to Cudworth in his 1795 work, “The Eolian Harp”:

And what if all of animated nature Be but organic Harps diversely fram’d,

That tremble into thought, as o’er them sweeps

Plastic and vast, one intellectual breeze,

At once the Soul of each, and God of all? (Coleridge, 1796)

He made the true depths of his debt to the Cambridge Platonists, in general, and to Cudworth, in particular, in Opus Maximum [Coleridge, Opus Maximum, I, Fragments 2-5 (pp. 16-27), and editorial commentary (pp. 300-305)].

In 1798, Coleridge moved to Germany, enrolling in the University of Gottingen. There, he discovered the works of Immanuel Kant and Gotthold Lessing. His fascination with these figures seems to be born of dissatisfaction with John Locke’s rejection of metaphysics. Kant initially seemed to have restored metaphysics to a place of respect by establishing the noumena as the objects of metaphysical contemplation. But then, in the mind of Coleridge, and the German Idealists, in general, he misfired by placing the noumenon beyond the reach of reason, abruptly aborting the project he nearly authorized. So, they began looking for another way and found Vitalism.

Coleridge particularly appreciated these ideas as they were expressed by Schelling. But he made clear in his autobiographical Notebooks that he had already encountered them at Cambridge, writing “Schelling and the Naturphilosophen are but imitators of our own Cambridge Platonists, though they know it not” (Coleridge, quoted in James Vigus, p. 233). He saw Cambridge Platonism even in Kant, saying “Cudworth’s Immutable Morality contains the germ and anticipation of all that is sound in Kant’s practical philosophy” (Coleridge, Aids to Reflection, Aphorism XXII, p. 210). And he hoped that through his study of German Idealism, he could revive the spirituality of “Platonic old England.” Coleridge saw in the German Idealists an effort to reverse the flaw that More saw in Descartes and Spinoza, and which Coleridge saw in Locke. Instead of explaining spiritual phenomena in terms of matter, empiricism, and science, Coleridge, like the Idealists, wanted to explain matter, empiricism, and science in terms of Spirit.

h. The Pantheist Controversy

To find and understand the Platonist influence that Coleridge detected, one must digress to review the infamous Pantheist Controversy (1783–1789). It began as a contest over how best to disagree with the Platonists’ old target, Spinoza. It became an inaugural moment in the development of German Idealism and Romanticism.

Within the German Enlightenment, Spinoza had come to be seen as an arch-atheist. Unfortunately, by 1780, Aufklärung, as the Germans called their Enlightenment, had achieved the fate of many reformist rebellions and had become, in the eyes of some, the new status quo against which one must rebel. It had great power and influence—some would say a stranglehold—on the culture’s intellectual community. But cracks were beginning to show.

Friedrich Heinrich Jacobi (1743–1819) was a critic of Aufklärung. He believed that the universal systemization and application of reason inevitably resulted in Materialism, Atheism, and Nihilism. In fact, he was the one who popularized the use of the term “Nihilism” in Modern Philosophy. To his mind, reason sifts through all human knowledge with a skeptical demand for justification at all points, undercutting all claims to authority, leaving, in the end, nothing on which to find or found faith, knowledge, and morality.

The philosopher playwright Gotthold Ephram Lessing (1720–1789) was a very popular and influential leader of Aufklärung. According to Jacobi, he had, in private conversation, praised the problematic Spinoza and challenged Jacobi to produce his own logical critique of Spinoza, instead of just parroting that of others. Lessing would die before Jacobi felt ready to provide a proper criticism of Spinoza. So, when Jacobi felt capable of debating the question, he turned, through correspondence, to Moses Mendelssohn, who had been a friend of Lessing and another leader of Aufklärung.

Jacobi saw that attributing Spinozism to Lessing would discredit Lessing and potentially discredit Aufklärung. Mendelssohn had wished to protect his friend’s memory from being tarnished by association with Spinoza. Ironically, the consequence of this literary debate was that the discovery that so respected a thinker as Lessing had studied Spinoza, redeemed Spinoza’s reputation, and set the future Idealists studying him, with Mendelssohn’s interpretation guiding these studies in a safely monotheist direction.

In Morning Hours, or Lectures about God’s Existence (1785). Mendelssohn suggested that Lessing only defended Spinoza for the sake of debate. Then, he accepted that Lessing might have believed in a form of Spinoza’s theory that was “purified” of atheism. Mendelssohn then outlined the beliefs of this “purified” pantheism, while stressing very clearly that he, himself, did not believe in it.

Lessing’s hypothetical pantheism simply posited that there is only one metaphysical substance, God. It is prior to all metaphysical truths, which might be deemed objects of His Self-contemplation. Then, He created the Universe based on these truths, producing matter, not as a primary substance, or a modality, but as a contingency. Thus, pantheism, the belief that the universe consisted only of different emanations of the same substance as God, was just a misunderstanding of a monotheistic metaphysics, mistaking contingent Matter for primary Spirit.

Returning, at last, to Cambridge, these future Idealists had access to the Platonists. Johann Lorenz von Mosheim published a full Latin translation of Cudworth’s True Intellectual System in 1713. A second edition was produced in 1733. This later edition of Cudworth was reviewed in the journal Allgemeine deutsche Bibliothek. They became a set text at the Tübinger Stift, a seminary of the Evangelical-Lutheran Church, where Friedrich Schelling (1775–1854), Friedrich Hölderlin (1770–1843), and Georg Wilhelm Friedrich Hegel (1770–1831) studied it in the 1780’s. The True System was also used at the University of Jena, which would become a seedbed of Romanticism.

In God: Five Conversations (1787), Johann von Herder opened a third front in this ongoing debate. He rejected Jacobi’s belief that any metaphysics must remain incomplete as leading to irrationalism. He also rejected Mendelssohn’s rationalism as abstract and void of actual life experience. He went back to Spinoza for an answer, simultaneously “improving” Spinoza’s theory much as Mendelssohn had. In the end, Von Herder accepted that matter and spirit were different principles. But he indicated that they were mediated by an organic principle, which he called Kraft: “the living Force” (Herder, p. 13). Thus, they were incorporated into an organic whole.

As von Herder expressed it, Spinoza had failed to reconcile the conflicting essential features of God and Nature due to the inferior scientific understanding of his generation. But, in the interim, science had discovered “substantial forces” such as Gravity, Electricity, and Magnetism (von Herder, pp. 30-40). These forces could shape and affect matter even though they were themselves immaterial.

Like Plastic Nature, Kraft would be responsible for the regularity of action in the material world but would not constrain freedom of will. God would be the Urkraft, or “meta-Force,” of which this Force would be an emanation. The similarities between Kraft and Plastic Nature suggest that Cudworth might have been an influence on von Herder (Hampton, pp. 422-427).

Johann Goethe (1749–1832) was a protégé of von Herder’s who directed him towards the study of Spinoza. Eventually, Goethe would treat his discovery of what we might call “Herder-ized Spinoza” as if it were a religious conversion. He even gave Kraft, or possibly the World Soul, cameos in Faust, calling it Erdgeist.

In 1787, the same year that von Herder published God: Five Conversations, Schelling also published “On the World Soul: an Hypothesis of Advanced Physics for the Interpretation of the General Organism” (1798). There, Schelling argued that the basic aim of science was to understand the universe as a single organic entity and that all forces and activities should be seen as different manifestations of this entity’s Weltseele (World-Soul).

There is no direct evidence suggesting Schelling had based his idea on Cudworth or the Platonists, or had been directly influenced by them, but he did certainly have access to them at the Tübinger Stift. These connections may account for Coleridge’s claim that “Schelling and the Naturphilosophen are but imitators of our own Cambridge Platonists, though they know it not” (Coleridge, quoted in James Vigus, p. 233). But the question remains controversial.

i. Summation

The Cambridge Platonists were among the first writers of philosophy in English, as well as the first to apply Plato, at least as he was understood at the time, to the issues of their day. Central to the work of the Cambridge Platonists was the tolerance from which they received their contemporary name, “Latitude Men.” To support this, the Platonists rested authority not on special revelations given to one person, or sect, but to something given to all humans: reason. They exalted reason to the point of being God’s defining trait. He was omniscient, but all this knowledge was ordered and operated according to His perfect logic. The created world and the human mind, as products of this omniscience, were also disciplined by this logic, but it was an imperfect logic because of the indirect contact between them and God’s mind.

Humans can understand the world by consulting the logical workings of their own minds, which parallel the order of nature, because both of these orderly processes were the product of God’s orderly mind. We might also understand morality, for the same reason. When this understanding was imperfect, our errors were not the fault of God.

The closer mankind came to wisdom, the closer it came to goodness, and so, to God. Religion went hand in hand with reason. Ethics was a necessary part of this project. And if Mankind had the ability to freely inquire, so was Man, to that extent, free, and, to that extent, good.

Reason served as the disciplining regulator of the universe through the mediation of an unconscious, nonmaterial force which operated throughout all space and time, governing causality along set and regular patterns that might be called The Laws of Nature, but which were more correctly called the Rationality of God. This regulator was, depending on who was writing, called Plastic Nature, the World Soul, Christ, and other things.

The material universe might become corrupt because this force is unconscious, and so could only operate automatically on general rules, and not make judgments. Special cases would require divine intervention and miracles. But the general operations of the universe were also indirectly a manifestation of a driving Rationality and Goodness.

This last idea, as it was expressed by Plato, developed by Plotinus, and transmitted to the Cambridge Platonists through Ficino and the Florentine Platonists, might have become a contribution of the Cambridge Platonists to the thinkers and artists of the next century. In their time, the ability to self-initiate action was seen as the defining trait of living things. But the development of experimental science and empirical epistemology seemed to reduce the universe to a dead mechanism, incapable of self-generated action. Through “plastic nature,” the Platonists returned life to a dead cosmos.

5. References and Further Readings

a. Primary Sources from Platonists

Conway, Anne. The Principles of the Most Ancient and Modern Philosophy. Edited by Allison P. Coudert and Taylor Corse, Cambridge University Press, 1996. Internet Archive, https://archive.org/details/principlesofmost0000conw..
- Conway’s sole published work.
Cudworth, Ralph. The True Intellectual System of the Universe. Edited by J. Harrison, based on Mosheim’s Latin edition, vol. 1, Thomas Tegg, 1845. Internet Archive, https://archive.org/details/trueintellectualsystem1845v1.
- The first part of Cudworth’s Trilogy, focuses on Metaphysics and Epistemology.
Cudworth, Ralph. A Treatise Concerning Eternal and Immutable Morality. London, 1731.
- Part Two of the Trilogy, focusing on Ethics.
Cudworth, Ralph. “A Treatise of Freewill.” Edited by John Allen, John W. Parker, 1838. HathiTrust Digital Library, https://catalog.hathitrust.org/Record/008977302.
- The Saga concludes, focusing on the problem of Free Will.
Culverwell, Nathaniel. An Elegant and Learned Discourse of the Light of Nature. London, 1652. Online Library of Liberty, https://oll.libertyfund.org/titles/greene-an-elegant-and-learned-discourse-of-the-light-of-nature.
- The first work published by a Cambridge Platonist, Culverwell’s only publication.
Masham, Damaris. A Discourse Concerning the Love of God. London, 1696.
- Lady Damaris’s Theology.
Masham, Damaris. Occasional Thoughts in Reference to a Vertuous or Christian Life. London, 1705. Internet Archive, https://archive.org/details/occasionalthough00mash.
- Lady Damaris on ethics and women’s rights.
More, Henry. An Antidote Against Atheism. London, 1653. Internet Archive, https://archive.org/details/antidoteagainsta00more.
- More’s first effort at rationalistic apologetic work.
More, Henry. An Explanation of the Grand Mystery of Godliness. London, 1660. Internet Archive, https://archive.org/details/bim_early-english-books-1641-1700_an-explanation-of-the-gr_more-henry_1660.
- More’s most complete exposition of his theology.
More, Henry. Enchiridion Ethicum. London, 1667. Internet Archive, https://archive.org/details/enchiridionethic00more.
- More’s Latin summation of his Theory of Ethics.
More, Henry. Enchiridion Metaphysicum. London, 1671. Internet Archive, https://archive.org/details/enchiridionmetap00more.
- A thorough attack on Descartes’s mechanism and exposition of the idea of the Spirit of Nature, in Latin.
More, Henry. Enthusiasmus Triumphatus: Or, A Discourse of the Nature, Causes, Kinds, and Cure of Enthusiasme. London, 1656. Internet Archive, https://archive.org/details/enthusiasmustri00more.
- More vs. Enthusiasm.
More, Henry. The Immortality of the Soul. London, 1659. Internet Archive, https://archive.org/details/immortalityofsou00more.
- More’s early defense of the soul’s incorporeality and immortality was written against Materialism and Mechanism.
More, Henry. Opera Omnia. 2 vols., London, 1675–79. Internet Archive, https://archive.org/details/henricimorisopera01more.
- More’s collection of his own works in Latin for a continental audience contains revised versions of many papers otherwise referenced above.
Smith, John. Select Discourses. Cambridge, 1660. Internet Archive, https://archive.org/details/selectdiscourses00smit.
- A posthumous collection of Smith’s work, generally sermons.
Tuckney, Anthony, and Benjamin Whichcote. Eight Letters of Dr. Antony Tuckney, and Dr. Benjamin Whichcote. 1753. Cambridge Platonism Sourcebook, University of Cambridge, https://www.cambridge-platonism.divinity.cam.ac.uk/texts/results.
- Tuckney and Whichcote’s dispute.
Whichcote, Benjamin. A Sermon Preached before the Honourable House of Commons, at Their Solemn Fast, April 30, 1647. London, 1647. https://quod.lib.umich.edu/e/eebo/A61474.0001.001?view=toc.
- Whichcote’s plea for moderation before Parliament.
Whichcote, Benjamin. The Moral and Religious Aphorisms of Benjamin Whichcote. Edited by Samuel Salter, Cambridge University Press, 1753.
- A posthumous collection of Whichcote’s aphorisms.
Whichcote, Benjamin. Several Discourses. London, 1689. Internet Archive, https://archive.org/details/severaldiscours00whic.
- A posthumous collection of Whichcote’s sermons.

b. Primary Sources from Others

Bayle, Pierre. “Cudworth.” Dictionnaire historique et critique. 4th ed., vol. 1, Amsterdam, Reinier Leers, 1734, pp. 761-769. Internet Archive, https://archive.org/details/dictionnairehist01bayl.
- Bayle’s most mature criticism of Cudworth.
Bayle, Pierre. Nouvelles de la République des Lettres. Rotterdam, Reinier Leers, 1684–1687. Internet Archive, https://archive.org/details/nouvellesdelarep1686bayl.
- Bayle’s first criticism of Cudworth.
Clarke, Samuel. A Collection of Papers, Which Passed Between the Late Learned Mr. Leibnitz, and Dr. Clarke, in the Years 1715 and 1716. James Knapton, 1717. Eighteenth Century Collections Online, Internet Archive, p. 121.
- Clarke vs. Leibniz concerning Newton.
Clarke, Samuel. A Discourse Concerning the Unchangeable Obligations of Natural Religion, and the Truth and Certainty of the Christian Revelation. W. Botham, 1706. Eighteenth Century Collections Online, Internet Archive.
- Clarke’s rationalist theology.
Clarke, Samuel. “Remarks upon a Book, Entitled, A Philosophical Enquiry Concerning Human Liberty.” The Works of Samuel Clarke, D. D., vol. 4, J. and P. Knapton, 1738. Eighteenth Century Collections Online. https://jmphil.org/article/id/2051
- Clarke’s polemics.
von Herder, Johann Gottfried. God: Some Conversations. Translated and edited by Frederick Burkhardt, Veritas Press, 1940. Internet Archive, https://archive.org/details/godsomeconversat0000herd.
- Von Herder’s book concerning Kraft.
Hume, David. An Enquiry Concerning the Principles of Morals. A. Millar, 1751. Eighteenth Century Collections Online, University of Michigan, https://quod.lib.umich.edu/cgi/t/text/text-idx?cc=ecco;c=ecco;idno=004806387.0001.000;node=004806387.0001.000:9.1;seq=81;view=text;rgn=div2
- Hume vs. Rationalistic Ethics.
Leibniz, G. W. Philosophical Papers and Letters. Edited and translated by Leroy E. Loemker, 2nd ed., Springer, 1969, pp. 586-587. https://link.springer.com/book/10.1007/978-94-010-1426-7.
- A translation of some of the works and correspondence of Leibniz.
Leibniz, G. W. Philosophical Texts. Edited and translated by R. S. Woolhouse and Richard Francks, Oxford University Press, 1998. Google Books, https://books.google.com/books/about/Philosophical_Texts.html?id=ctBuQgAACAAJ.
- Another translation of some of the works and correspondences of Leibniz.
Locke, John. The Reasonableness of Christianity. Stanford University Press, 1958. Internet Archive, https://archive.org/details/reasonablenessof00lockuoft.
- Locke on faith and reason, as well as tolerance.
Locke, John. An Essay Concerning Human Understanding. London: Penguin, 1997. Internet Archive, https://archive.org/details/humanunderstandi00lockuoft.
- Locke on reason.
Schelling, Friedrich Wilhelm Joseph. On the World Soul: An Hypothesis of Higher Physics for Explaining Universal Organism. 1798. Translated and introduced by Iain Hamilton Grant, Collapse VI, 2010, pp. 58-95. https://1library.net/document/z3dxkj8y-f-w-j-schelling-world-soul-translation.html.
- Schelling on the World Soul.
Shaftesbury, Anthony Ashley Cooper, 3rd Earl of. Characteristicks of Men, Manners, Opinions, Times. London, 1711. Internet Archive, https://archive.org/details/characteristicso02shaf.
Westminster Assembly. The Westminster Confession of Faith. Westminster Theological Seminary, https://wts.edu/wcf.
- Defining Calvinist beliefs and doctrine.

c. Secondary Sources

Armstrong, Robert L. “Cambridge Platonists and John Locke on Innate Ideas” Journal of the History of Ideas, vol. 30, no. 2, pp. 187-202.
- Concerning the debate between the Platonists and Locke concerning innate ideas.
Hampton, Alexander. “An English Source of German Romanticism: Herder’s Cudworth Inspired Revision of Spinoza from ‘Plastik’ to ‘Kraft.’” Heythrop Journal, vol. 58, no. 3, 2017, pp. 417-431. Wiley Online Library, https://onlinelibrary.wiley.com/doi/10.1111/heyj.12301.
- Discusses the Cambridge Platonist influence on the Vitalist Controversy.
Howe, Daniel Walker. 1988. “The Cambridge Platonists of Old England and the Cambridge Platonists of New England.” Church History, vol. 57, no. 4, pp. 470-85. https://doi.org/10.2307/3166653.
- Concerning the role of the Cambridge Platonists in colonial American thinking, especially at Harvard.
Joseph, Jacques. “Henry More’s ‘Spirit of Nature’ and Newton’s Aether.” Teorie Vědy / Theory of Science, vol. 38, no. 3, 2016, pp. 337-358. Teorie Vědy, https://teorievedy.flu.cas.cz/index.php/tv/article/view/357.https://www.academia.edu/34027264/HENRY_MORES_SPIRIT_OF_NATURE_AND_NEWTONS_AETHER.
- Concerning the similarities between Newton’s Aether and More’s World Soul.
Reid, Jasper. “The Evolution of Henry More’s Theory of Divine Absolute Space.” Journal of the History of Philosophy, vol. 45, no. 1, Jan. 2007, pp. 79-102. Project MUSE, https://muse.jhu.edu/article/208921.
- On More’s concept of Absolute Space.
Reid, Jasper. “Newton and the Cambridge Platonists.” Encyclopedia of Early Modern Philosophy and the Sciences, edited by Dana Jalobeanu and Charles T. Wolfe, Springer, 2022, pp. 1493-1504. https://doi.org/10.1007/978-3-319-31069-5_114.
- On More’s role in the development of Newton’s theories.
Schroeder, Steven. “Anne Conway’s Place: A Map of Leibniz.” The Pluralist, vol. 2, no. 3, 2007, pp. 77-99. JSTOR, https://www.jstor.org/stable/20708916.
- Anne Conway’s role in shaping the thought of Leibniz.
Tulloch, John. Rational Theology and Christian Philosophy in England in the 17th Century. Vol. 1, Edinburgh: T. & T. Clark, 1872. Internet Archive, https://archive.org/details/rationaltheolog05tullgoog.
- About the theology of the Cambridge Platonists.
Vigus, James. 2019. “‘This Is Not Quite Fair, Master More!’: Coleridge and the Cambridge Platonists.” Archives Internationales d’Histoire Des Idées, January, pp. 191-214. https://doi.org/10.1007/978-3-030-22200-0_12.
- About the role of the Cambridge Platonists in shaping the beliefs of Samuel Taylor Coleridge.

d. Further Readings

De Tommaso, Emilio Maria. “The Debate on Plastic Natures in the Correspondence between Masham and Leibniz Epistolary Exchanges as an Intellectual Framework in the République des Lettres.” Lo Sguardo – Rivista Di Filosofia, July 2024, https://doi.org/10.5281/zenodo.14811817.
- Discusses Masham’s association with Leibniz and its role in the development of his thinking.
Hengstermann, Christian. “Divine Goodness and Human Freedom in Henry More’s Critique of Baruch de Spinoza.” Participation in the Divine: A Philosophical History, from Antiquity to the Modern Era, edited by Douglas Hedley and Daniel J. Tolan, Cambridge University Press, 2024, pp. 312-330.
- A discussion of More’s criticism of Spinoza.
Hedley, Douglas, and Christian Hengstermann, editors. An Anthology of the Cambridge Platonists. Taylor & Francis, 2023.
- A treasury of primary and secondary sources on the Cambridge Platonists.
Hedley, Douglas, and David Leech, editors. Revisioning Cambridge Platonism: Sources and Legacy. Springer, 2019. International Archives of the History of Ideas / Archives internationales d’histoire des idées, vol. 222.
- Discussions of the role of the Cambridge Platonists in connecting Renaissance philosophy with Modernism.
Hutton, Sarah. 2021. “Damaris Masham, Ralph Cudworth and John Locke: Some Philosophical Continuities.” Studia Z Historii Filozofii, vol. 12, no. 3, pp. 11-35. https://doi.org/10.12775/szhf.2021.013.
- Discusses the role of Damaris Masham in exposing Cambridge Platonist thinking to Locke.
Kaldas, Samuel M. The Cambridge Platonists and Early Modern Philosophy. Cambridge University Press, 2024. Cambridge Core, https://www.cambridge.org/core/books/cambridge-platonists-and-early-modern-philosophy/E693DC05664A26D25B37032329A2AE9B.
- An introduction to the Cambridge Platonists and the religious controversies of their day.
Rogers, G. A. J. “Locke, Newton, and the Cambridge Platonists on Innate Ideas.” Journal of the History of Ideas, vol. 40, no. 2, Apr. 1979, pp. 191-205. JSTOR, https://www.jstor.org/stable/2709148.
- On the Cambridge Platonist conception of innate ideas.
Uehlein, Friedrich A. “Whichcote, Shaftesbury and Locke: Shaftesbury’s Critique of Locke’s Epistemology and Moral Philosophy.” British Journal for the History of Philosophy, vol. 25, no. 5, 21 Aug. 2017, pp. 1031-1048.
- About the intellectual relationship between Whichcote, Shaftsbury, and Locke.

Author Information

Charles M. Richards
Email: CharlesRichards@rsu.edu
Rogers State University, Chamberlain University
U. S. A.