The New Atheists

The New Atheists are authors of early twenty-first century books promoting atheism. These authors include Sam Harris, Richard Dawkins, Daniel Dennett, and Christopher Hitchens. The “New Atheist” label for these critics of religion and religious belief emerged out of journalistic commentary on the contents and impacts of their books. A standard observation is that New Atheist authors exhibit an unusually high level of confidence in their views.  Reviewers have noted that these authors tend to be motivated by a sense of moral concern and even outrage about the effects of religious beliefs on the global scene. It is difficult to identify anything philosophically unprecedented in their positions and arguments, but the New Atheists have provoked considerable controversy with their body of work.

In spite of their different approaches and occupations (only Dennett is a professional philosopher), the New Atheists tend to share a general set of assumptions and viewpoints. These positions constitute the background theoretical framework that is known as the New Atheism. The framework has a metaphysical component, an epistemological component, and an ethical component.  Regarding the metaphysical component, the New Atheist authors share the central belief that there is no supernatural or divine reality of any kind.  The epistemological component is their common claim that religious belief is irrational. The moral component is the assumption that there is a universal and objective secular moral standard. This moral component sets them apart from other prominent historical atheists such as Nietzsche and Sartre, and it plays a pivotal role in their arguments because it is used to conclude that religion is bad in various ways, although Dennett is more reserved than the other three.

The New Atheists make substantial use of the natural sciences in both their criticisms of theistic belief and in their proposed explanations of its origin and evolution. They draw on science for recommended alternatives to religion. They believe empirical science is the only (or at least the best) basis for genuine knowledge of the world, and they insist that a belief can be epistemically justified only if it is based on adequate evidence. Their conclusion is that science fails to show that there is a God and even supports the claim that such a being probably does not exist. What science will show about religious belief, they claim, is that this belief can be explained as a product of biological evolution. Moreover, they think that it is possible to live a satisfying non-religious life on the basis of secular morals and scientific discoveries.

Table of Contents

1. Faith and Reason
2. Arguments For and Against God’s Existence
3. Evolution and Religious Belief
4. The Moral Evaluation of Religion
5. Secular Morality
6. Alleged Divine Revelations
7. Secular Fulfillment
8. Criticism of the New Atheists
9. References and Further Reading

1. Faith and Reason

Though it is difficult to find a careful and precise definition of “faith” in the writings of the New Atheists, it is possible to glean a general characterization of this cognitive attitude from various things they say about it. In The Selfish Gene, Richard Dawkins states that faith is blind trust without evidence and even against the evidence. He follows up in The God Delusion with the claim that faith is an evil because it does not require justification and does not tolerate argument. Whereas the former categorization suggests that Dawkins thinks that faith is necessarily non-rational or even irrational, the latter description seems to imply that faith is merely contingently at odds with rationality. Harris’s articulation of the nature of faith is closer to Dawkins’ earlier view. He says that religious faith is unjustified belief in matters of ultimate concern.  According to Harris, faith is the permission religious people give one another to believe things strongly without evidence. Hitchens says that religious faith is ultimately grounded in wishful thinking. For his part, Dennett implies that belief in God cannot be reasonable because the concept of God is too radically indeterminate for the sentence “God exists” to express a genuine proposition.  Given this, Dennett questions whether any of the people who claim to believe in God actually do believe God exists. He thinks it more likely that they merely profess belief in God or “believe in belief” in God (they believe belief in God is or would be a good thing). According to this view there can be no theistic belief that is also reasonable or rational. Critics point out that the New Atheist assumption that religious faith is irrational is at odds with a long philosophical history in the West that often characterizes faith as rational.  This Western Philosophical tradition can be said to begin with Augustine and continue through to present times.

The New Atheists subscribe to some version or other of scientism as their criterion for rational belief.  According to scientism, empirical science is the only source of our knowledge of the world (strong scientism) or, more moderately, the best source of rational belief about the way things are (weak scientism). Harris and Dawkins are quite explicit about this. Harris equates a genuinely rational approach to spiritual and ethical questions with a scientific approach to these sorts of questions. Dawkins insists that the presence or absence of a creative super-intelligence is a scientific question. The New Atheists also affirm evidentialism, the claim that a belief can be epistemically justified only if it is based on adequate evidence. The conjunction of scientism and evidentialism entails that a belief can be justified only if it is based on adequate scientific evidence. The New Atheists’ conclusion that belief in God is unjustified follows, then, from their addition of the claim that there is inadequate scientific evidence for God’s existence (and even adequate scientific evidence for God’s non-existence).  Dawkins argues that the “God Hypothesis” the claim that there exists a superhuman, supernatural intelligence who deliberately designed and created the universe, is “founded on local traditions of private revelation rather than evidence” (2006, pp. 31-32). Given these New Atheist epistemological assumptions (and their consequences for religious epistemology), it is not surprising that some criticism of their views has included questions about whether there is adequate scientific support for scientism and whether there is adequate evidence for evidentialism.

2. Arguments For and Against God’s Existence

Since atheism continues to be a highly controversial philosophical position, one would expect that the New Atheists would devote a fair amount of space to a careful (and, of course, critical) consideration of arguments for God’s existence  and that they would also spend a corresponding amount of time formulating a case for the non-existence of God.  However, none of them addresses either theistic or atheistic arguments to any great extent. Dawkins does devote a chapter apiece to each of these tasks, but he has been criticized for engaging in an overly cursory evaluation of theistic arguments and for ignoring the philosophical literature in natural theology.   The literature overlooked by Dawkins addresses issues relevant to his claim that there almost certainly is no God. Harris, who thinks that atheism is obviously true, does not dedicate much space to a discussion of arguments for or against theism.  He does sketch a brief version of the cosmological argument for God’s existence but asserts that the final conclusion does not follow because the argument does not rule out alternative possibilities for the universe’s existence. Harris also hints at reasons to deny God’s existence by pointing to unexplained evil and “unintelligent design” in the world. Hitchens includes chapters entitled “The Metaphysical Claims of Religion are False” and “Arguments from Design,” but his more journalistic treatment of the cases for and against God’s existence amounts primarily to the claim that the God hypothesis is unnecessary since science can now explain what theism was formerly thought to be required to explain, including phenomena such as the appearance of design in the universe. After considering the standard arguments for God’s existence and rehearsing standard objections to them, Dennett argues that the concept of God is insufficiently determinate for it to be possible to know what proposition is at issue in the debate over God’s existence.

Dawkins’ argument for the probable non-existence of God is the most explicit and thorough attempt at an atheistic argument amongst the four. However, he does not state this argument in a deductively valid form, so it is difficult to discern exactly what he has in mind. Dawkins labels his argument for God’s non-existence “the Ultimate Boeing 747 gambit,” because he thinks that God’s existence is at least as improbable as the chance that a hurricane, sweeping through a scrap yard, would have the luck to assemble a Boeing 747 (an image that he borrows from Fred Hoyle, who used it for a different purpose). At the heart of his argument is the claim that any God capable of designing a universe must be a supremely complex and improbable entity who needs an even bigger explanation than the one the existence of such a God is supposed to provide. Dawkins also says that the hypothesis that an intelligent designer created the universe is self-defeating. What he appears to mean by this charge is that this intelligent design hypothesis claims to provide an ultimate explanation for all existing improbable complexity and yet cannot provide an explanation of its own improbable complexity. Dawkins further states that the God hypothesis creates a vicious regress rather than terminating one. Similarly, Harris follows Dawkins’ in arguing that the notion of a creator God leads to an infinite regress because such a being would have to have been created. Some critics, like William Lane Craig, reply that, at best, Dawkins’ argument could show only that the God hypothesis does not explain the appearance of design in the universe (a claim that Craig denies) but it does not demonstrate that God probably doesn’t exist. Dawkins’ assumption that God would need an extenal cause flies in the face of the longstanding theological assumption that God is a perfect and so necessary being who is consequently self-existent and ontologically independent. At the very least, Dawkins owes the defender of this classical conception of God further clarification of the kind of complexity he attributes to God and further arguments for the claims that God possesses this kind of complexity and that God’s being complex in this way is incompatible with God’s being self-existent. In reply to Dawkins, Craig argues that though the contents of God’s mind may be complex, God’s mind itself is simple.

3. Evolution and Religious Belief

The New Atheists observe that if there is no supernatural reality, then religion and religious belief must have a purely natural explanation. They agree that these sociological and psychological phenomena are rooted in biology. Harris summarizes their view by saying that as a biological phenomenon, religion is the product of cognitive processes that have deep roots in our evolutionary past. Dawkins endorses the general hypothesis that religion and religious belief are byproducts of something else that has survival value. His specific hypothesis is that human beings have acquired religious beliefs because there is a selective advantage to child brains that possess the rule of thumb to believe, without question, whatever familiar adults tell them. Dawkins speculates that this cognitive disposition, which tends to help inexperienced children to avoid harm, also tends to make them susceptible to acquiring their elders’ irrational and harmful religious beliefs. Dawkins is less committed to this specific hypothesis than he is to the general hypothesis, and he is open to other specific hypotheses of the same kind. Dennett discusses a number of these specific hypotheses more thoroughly in his attempt to “break the spell” he identifies as the taboo against a thorough scientific investigation of religion as one natural phenomenon among many.

At the foundation of Dennett’s “proto-theory” about the origin of religion and religious belief is his appeal to the evolution in humans (and other animals) of a “hyperactive agent detection device” (HADD), which is the disposition to attribute agency – beliefs and desires and other mental states – to anything complicated that moves. Dennett adds that when an event is sufficiently puzzling, our “weakness for certain sorts of memorable combos” cooperates with our HADD to constitute “a kind of fiction-generating contraption” that hypothesizes the existence of invisible and even supernatural agents (2006, pp. 119-120). Dennett goes on to engage in a relatively extensive speculation about how religion and religious belief evolved from these purely natural beginnings. Though Hitchens mentions Dennett’s naturalistic approach to religion in his chapter on “religion’s corrupt beginnings,” he focuses primarily on the interplay between a pervasive gullibility he takes to be characteristic of human beings and the exploitation of this credulity that he attributes to the founders of religions and religious movements. The scientific investigation of religion of the sort Dennett recommends has prompted a larger interdisciplinary conversation that includes both theists and non-theists with academic specialties in science, philosophy, and theology (see Schloss and Murray 2009 for an important example of this sort of collaboration).

4. The Moral Evaluation of Religion

The New Atheists agree that, although religion may have been a byproduct of certain human qualities that proved important for survival, religion itself is not necessarily a beneficial social and cultural phenomenon on balance at present. Indeed, three of the New Atheists (Harris, Dawkins, and Hitchens) are quite explicit in their moral condemnation of religious people on the ground that religious beliefs and practices have had significant and predominately negative consequences. The examples they provide of such objectionable behaviors range from the uncontroversial (suicide bombings, the Inquisition, “religious” wars, witch hunts, homophobia, etc.) to the controversial (prohibition of “victimless crimes” such as drug use and prostitution, criminalization of abortion and euthanasia,  “child abuse” due to identification of children as members of their parents religious communities, and so forth). Harris is explicit about placing the blame for these evils on faith, defined as unfounded belief. He argues that faith in what religious believers take to be God’s will as revealed in God’s book inevitably leads to immoral behaviors of these sorts. In this way, the New Atheists link their epistemological critique of religious belief with their moral criticism of religion.

The New Atheists counter the claim that religion makes people good by listing numerous examples of the preceding sort in which religion allegedly makes people bad. They also anticipate the reply that the moral consequences of atheism are worse than those of theism. A typical case for this claim appeals to the atrocities perpetrated by people like Hitler and Stalin. The New Atheists reply that Hitler was not necessarily an atheist because he claimed to be a Christian and that these regimes were evil because they were influenced by religion or were like a religion and that, even if their leaders were atheists (as in the case of Stalin), their crimes against humanity were not caused by their atheism because they were not carried out in the name of atheism. The New Atheists seem to be  agreed that theistic belief has generally worse attitudinal and behavioral moral consequences than atheistic belief. Dennett is characteristically more hesitant to draw firm conclusions along these lines until further empirical investigation is undertaken..

5. Secular Morality

These moral objections to religion presuppose a moral standard. Since the New Atheists have denied the existence of any supernatural reality, this moral standard has to have a purely natural and secular basis. Many non-theists have located the natural basis for morality in human convention, a move that leads naturally to ethical relativism. But the New Atheists either explicitly reject ethical relativism, or affirm the existence of the “transcendent value” of justice, or assert that there is a consensus about what we consider right and wrong, or simply engage in a moral critique of religion that implicitly presupposes a universal moral standard.

The New Atheists’ appeal to a universal secular moral standard raises some interesting philosophical questions. First, what is the content of morality? Harris comes closest to providing an explicit answer to that question in stating that questions of right and wrong are really questions about the happiness and suffering of sentient creatures. Second, if the content of morality is not made accessible to human beings by means of a revelation of God’s will, then how do humans know what the one moral standard is? The New Atheists seem to be agreed that we have foundational moral knowledge. Harris calls the source of this basic moral knowledge “moral intuition.” Since the other New Atheists don’t argue for the moral principles to which they appeal, it seems reasonable to conclude that they would agree with Harris. Third, what is the ontological ground of the universal moral standard? Given the assumption that ethical relativism is false, the question arises concerning what the objective natural ground is that makes it the case that some people are virtuous and some are not and that some behaviors are morally right and some are not. Again, Harris’s view that our ethical intuitions have their roots in biology is representative. Dawkins provides “four good Darwinian reasons” that purport to explain why some animals (including, of course human beings) engage in moral behavior. And though Dennett’s focus is on the evolution of religion, he is likely to have a similar story about the evolution of morality. One problem with this biological answer to our philosophical question is that it could only explain what causes moral behavior; it can’t also account for what makes moral principles true. The fourth philosophical question raised by the New Atheists is one they address themselves: “Why should we be moral?” Harris’s answer is that being moral tends to contribute to one’s happiness. Dawkins’ reply to the critic who asks, “If there’s no God, why be good?” seems to amount to no more than the observation that there are moral atheists. But this could only show that belief in God is not needed to motivate people to be moral; it doesn’t explain what does (or should) motivate atheists to be moral.

6. Alleged Divine Revelations

If there is no divine being, then there are no divine revelations. If there are no divine revelations, then every sacred book is a merely human book. Harris, Dawkins, and Hitchens each construct a case for the claim that no alleged written divine revelation could have a divine origin. Their arguments for this conclusion focus on what they take to be the moral deficiencies and factual errors of these books. Harris quotes passages from the part of the Old Testament traditionally labeled the “Law” that he considers barbaric and then asserts (on the basis of his view that Jesus can be read to endorse the entirety of Old Testament law) that the New Testament does not improve on these injunctions. He says that any subsequent more moderate Christian migration away from these biblical legal requirements is a result of taking scripture less and less seriously. Dawkins agrees with Harris that the God of the Bible and the Qur’an is not a moderate. As a matter of fact, he says that “The God of the Old Testament is arguably the most unpleasant character in all of fiction” (Dawkins 2006, p. 31). Though he says that “Jesus is a huge improvement over the cruel ogre of the Old Testament” (Dawkins 2006, p. 25), he argues that the doctrine of atonement, “which lies at the heart of New Testament theology, is almost as morally obnoxious as the story of Abraham setting out to barbecue Isaac” (Dawkins 2006, p. 251). Hitchens adds his own similar criticisms of both testaments in two chapters: “The Nightmare of the ‘Old’ Testament” and “The ‘New’ Testament Exceeds the Evil of the ‘Old’ One.” He also devotes a chapter to the Qur’an (as does Harris) and a section to the Book of Mormon. Dennett hints at a different objection to the Bible by remarking that anybody can quote the Bible to prove anything.

This collective case against the authenticity of any alleged written divine revelation raises interesting questions in philosophical theology about what kind of book could qualify as “God’s Word.” For instance, Harris considers it astonishing that a book as “ordinary” as the Bible is nonetheless thought to be a product of omniscience. He also says that, whereas the Bible contains no formal discussion of mathematics and some obvious mathematical errors, a book written by an omniscient being could contain a chapter on mathematics that would still be the richest source of mathematical insight humanity has ever known. This sort of claim invites further discussion about the sorts of purposes God would have and strategies God would employ in communicating with human beings in different times and places.

7. Secular Fulfillment

Each of the New Atheists recommends or at least alludes to a non-religious means of personal fulfillment and even collective well-being. Harris advocates a “spirituality” that involves meditation leading to happiness through an eradication of one’s sense of self. He thinks that scientific exploration into the nature of human consciousness will provide a progressively more adequate natural and rational basis for such a practice. For inspiration in a Godless world, Dawkins looks to the power of science to open the mind and satisfy the psyche. He celebrates the liberation of human beings from ignorance due to the growing and assumedly limitless capacity of science to explain the universe and everything in it. Hitchens hints at his own source of secular satisfaction by claiming that the natural is wondrous enough for anyone. He expresses his hope for a renewed Enlightenment focused on human beings, based on unrestricted scientific inquiry, and eventually productive of a new humane civilization. Dennett believes that a purely naturalistic spirituality is possible through a selfless attitude characterized by humble curiosity about the world’s complexities resulting in a realization of the relative unimportance of one’s personal preoccupations.

8. Criticism of the New Atheists

A number of essays and books have been written in response to the New Atheists (see the “References and Further Reading” section below for some titles). Some of these works are supportive of them and some of them are critical. Other works include both positive and negative evaluations of the New Atheism. Clearly, the range of philosophical issues raised by the New Atheists’ claims and arguments is broad. As might be expected, attention has been focused on their epistemological views, their metaphysical assumptions, and their axiological positions. Their presuppositions should prompt more discussion in the fields of philosophical theology, philosophy of science, philosophical hermeneutics, the relation between science and religion, and historiography. Conversations about the New Atheists’ stances and rationales have also taken place in the form of debates between Harris, Dawkins, Hitchens, and Dennett and defenders of religious belief and religion such as Dinesh D’Souza, who has published his own defense of Christianity in response to the New Atheists’ arguments. These debates are accessible in a number of places on the Internet. Finally, the challenges to religion posed by the New Atheists have also prompted a number of seminars and conferences. One of these is a conference presented by the Center for Philosophy of Religion at the University of Notre Dame, entitled, “My Ways Are Not Your Ways: The Character of the God of the Hebrew Bible” ( 2009). For an introduction to the sorts of issues this conference addresses, see Copan 2008.

9. References and Further Reading

• Berlinski, David. The Devil’s Delusion: Atheism and its Scientific Pretensions (New York: Crown Forum, 2008).
  • A response to the New Atheists by a secular Jew that defends traditional religious thought.
• Copan, Paul. “Is Yahweh a Moral Monster? The New Atheists and Old Testament Ethics,” Philosophia Christi 10:1, 2008, pp. 7-37.
  • A defense of the God and ethics of the Old Testament against the New Atheists’ criticisms of them.
• Copan, Paul and William Lane Craig, eds. Contending with Christianity’s Critics (Nashville, Tenn.: Broadman and Holman, 2009).
  • A collection of essays by Christian apologists that addresses challenges from New Atheists and other contemporary critics of Christianity.
• Craig, William Lane, ed. God is Great, God is Good: Why Believing in God is Reasonable and Responsible (Grand Rapids: InterVarsity Press, 2009).
  • A collection of essays by philosophers and theologians defending the rationality of theistic belief from the attacks of the New Atheists and others.
• Dawkins, Richard. The Selfish Gene, 2^nd ed. (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1989).
  • An explanation and defense of biological evolution by natural selection that focuses on the gene.
• Dawkins, Richard. The God Delusion (Boston: Houghton Mifflin, 2006).
  • A case for the irrationality and immoral consequences of religious belief that draws primarily on evolutionary biology.
• Dennett, Daniel. Breaking the Spell: Religion as a Natural Phenomenon (New York: Penguin, 2006).
  • A case for studying the history and practice of religion by means of the natural sciences.
• D’Souza, Dinesh. What’s So Great About Christianity (Carol Stream, IL: Tyndale House Publishers, 2007).
  • A defense of Christianity against the criticisms of the New Atheists.
• Eagleton, Terry. Reason, Faith, and Revolution: Reflections on the God Debate (New Haven: Yale University Press, 2009).
  • A critical reply to Dawkins and Hitchens (“Ditchkins”) by a Marxist literary critic.
• Flew, Antony. There is a God: How the World’s Most Notorious Atheist Changed His Mind (New York: HarperOne, 2007).
  • A former atheistic philosopher’s account of his conversion to theism (which includes a section by co-author Roy Abraham Varghese that provides a critical appraisal of the New Atheism).
• Harris, Sam. The End of Faith: Religion, Terror, and the Future of Reason (New York: Norton, 2004).
  • An intellectual and moral critique of faith-based religions that recommends their replacement by science-based spirituality.
• Harris, Sam. Letter to a Christian Nation (New York: Vintage Books, 2008).
  • A revised edition of his 2006 response to Christian reactions to his 2004 book.
• Hitchens, Christopher. God is Not Great: How Religion Poisons Everything (New York: Twelve, 2007).
  • A journalistic case against religion and religious belief.
• Keller, Timothy. The Reason for God: Belief in God in an Age of Skepticism (New York: Dutton, 2007).
  • A Christian minister’s reply to objections against Christianity of the sort raised by the New Atheists together with his positive case for Christianity.
• Kurtz, Paul. Forbidden Fruit: The Ethics of Secularism (Amherst, New York: Prometheus Books, 2008).
  • A case for an atheistic secular humanistic ethics by a philosopher.
• McGrath, Alister and Joanna Collicutt McGrath. The Dawkins Delusion? Atheist Fundamentalism and the Denial of the Divine (Downers Grove, IL: InterVarsity Press, 2007).
  • A critical engagement with the arguments set out in Dawkins 2006.
• Ray, Darrel W. The God Virus: How Religion Infects Our Lives and Culture (IPC Press, 2009).
  • A book by an organizational psychologist that purports to explain how religion has negative consequences for both individuals and societies.
• Schloss, Jeffrey and Michael Murray, eds. The Believing Primate: Scientific, Philosophical, and Theological Reflections on the Origin of Religion (New York: Oxford University Press, 2009).
  • An interdisciplinary discussion of issues raised by the sort of naturalistic account of religion promoted in Dennett 2006 and elsewhere.
• Stenger, Victor. God: The Failed Hypothesis. How Science Shows That God Does Not Exist (Prometheus Books, 2008).
  • A scientific case for the non-existence of God by a physicist.
• Stenger, Victor. The New Atheism: Taking a Stand for Science and Reason (Prometheus Books, 2009).
  • A defense of the New Atheism by a physicist.
• Ward, Keith. Is Religion Dangerous? (Grand Rapids: Eerdmans, 2006).
  • A defense of religion against the New Atheists’ arguments by a philosopher-theologian.

Author Information

James E. Taylor
Email: taylor@westmont.edu
Westmont College
U. S. A.

Atheism

The term “atheist” describes a person who does not believe that God or a divine being exists.  Worldwide there may be as many as a billion atheists, although social stigma, political pressure, and intolerance make accurate polling difficult.

For the most part, atheists have presumed that the most reasonable conclusions are the ones that have the best evidential support.  And they have argued that the evidence in favor of God’s existence is too weak, or the arguments in favor of concluding there is no God are more compelling.  Traditionally the arguments for God’s existence have fallen into several families: ontological, teleological, and cosmological arguments, miracles, and prudential justifications.  For detailed discussion of those arguments and the major challenges to them that have motivated the atheist conclusion, the reader is encouraged to consult the other relevant sections of the encyclopedia.

Arguments for the non-existence of God are deductive or inductive.  Deductive arguments for the non-existence of God are either single or multiple property disproofs that allege that there are logical or conceptual problems with one or several properties that are essential to any being worthy of the title “God.”  Inductive arguments typically present empirical evidence that is employed to argue that God’s existence is improbable or unreasonable.  Briefly stated, the main arguments are:  God’s non-existence is analogous to the non-existence of Santa Claus.  The existence of widespread human and non-human suffering is incompatible with an all powerful, all knowing, all good being.  Discoveries about the origins and nature of the universe, and about the evolution of life on Earth make the God hypothesis an unlikely explanation.  Widespread non-belief and the lack of compelling evidence show that a God who seeks belief in humans does not exist.  Broad considerations from science that support naturalism, or the view that all and only physical entities and causes exist, have also led many to the atheism conclusion.

The presentation below provides an overview of concepts, arguments, and issues that are central to work on atheism.

Table of Contents

1. What is Atheism?
2. The Epistemology of Atheism
3. Deductive Atheology
   1. Single Property Disproofs
   2. Multiple Property Disproofs
   3. Failure of Proof Disproof
4. Inductive Atheology
   1. The Prospects for Inductive Proof
   2. The Santa Claus Argument
   3. Problem of Evil
   4. Cosmology
   5. Teleological Arguments
   6. Arguments from Nonbelief
   7. Atheistic Naturalism
5. Cognitivism and Non-Cognitivism
6. Future Prospects for Atheism
7. References and Further Reading

1. What is Atheism?

Atheism is the view that there is no God.  Unless otherwise noted, this article will use the term “God” to describe the divine entity that is a central tenet of the major monotheistic religious traditions–Christianity, Islam, and Judaism.  At a minimum, this being is usually understood as having all power, all knowledge, and being infinitely good or morally perfect.  See the article Western Concepts of God for more details.  When necessary, we will use the term “gods” to describe all other lesser or different  characterizations of divine beings, that is, beings that lack some, one, or all of the omni- traits.

There have been many thinkers in history who have lacked a belief in God.  Some ancient Greek philosophers, such as Epicurus, sought natural explanations for natural phenomena. Epicurus was also to first to question the compatibility of God with suffering.  Forms of philosophical naturalism that would replace all supernatural explanations with natural ones also extend into ancient history.  During the Enlightenment, David Hume and Immanuel Kant give influential critiques of the traditional arguments for the existence of God in the 18^th century.  After Darwin (1809-1882) makes the case for evolution and some modern advancements in science, a fully articulated philosophical worldview that denies the existence of God gains traction.  In the 19^th and 20^th centuries, influential critiques on God, belief in God, and Christianity by Nietzsche, Feuerbach, Marx, Freud, and Camus set the stage for modern atheism.

It has come to be widely accepted that to be an atheist is to affirm the non-existence of God.  Anthony Flew (1984) called this positive atheism, whereas to lack a belief that God or gods exist is to be a negative atheist. Parallels for this use of the term would be terms such as “amoral,” “atypical,” or “asymmetrical.”  So negative atheism would includes someone who has never reflected on the question of whether or not God exists and has no opinion about the matter and someone who had thought about the matter a great deal and has concluded either that she has insufficient evidence to decide the question, or that the question cannot be resolved in principle.  Agnosticism is traditionally characterized as neither believing that God exists nor believing that God does not exist.

Atheism can be narrow or wide in scope.  The narrow atheist does not believe in the existence of God (an omni- being).  A wide atheist does not believe that any gods exist, including but not limited to the traditional omni-God.  The wide positive atheist denies that God exists, and also denies that Zeus, Gefjun, Thor, Sobek, Bakunawa and others exist.  The narrow atheist does not believe that God exists, but need not take a stronger view about the existence or non-existence of other supernatural beings.  One could be a narrow atheist about God, but still believe in the existence of some other supernatural entities.  (This is one of the reasons that it is a mistake to identify atheism with materialism or naturalism.)

Separating these different senses of the term allows us to better understand the different sorts of justification that can be given for varieties of atheism with different scopes.  An argument may serve to justify one form of atheism and not another.  For Instance, alleged contradictions within a Christian conception of God by themselves do not serve as evidence for wide atheism, but presumably, reasons that are adequate to show that there is no omni-God would be sufficient to show that there is no Islamic God.

2. The Epistemology of Atheism

We can divide the justifications for atheism into several categories.  For the most part, atheists have taken an evidentialist approach to the question of God’s existence.  That is, atheists have taken the view that whether or not a person is justified in having an attitude of belief towards the proposition, “God exists,” is a function of that person’s evidence.  “Evidence” here is understood broadly to include a priori arguments, arguments to the best explanation, inductive and empirical reasons, as well as deductive and conceptual premises.  An asymmetry exists between theism and atheism in that atheists have not offered faith as a justification for non-belief.  That is, atheists have not presented non-evidentialist defenses for believing that there is no God.

Not all theists appeal only to faith, however.  Evidentialists theist and evidentialist atheists may have a number of general epistemological principles concerning evidence, arguments, and implication in common, but then disagree about what the evidence is, how it should be understood, and what it implies.  They may disagree, for instance, about whether the values of the physical constants and laws in nature constitute evidence for intentional fine tuning, but agree at least that whether God exists is a matter that can be explored empirically or with reason.

Many non-evidentialist theists may deny that the acceptability of particular religious claim depends upon evidence, reasons, or arguments as they have been classically understood.  Faith or prudential based beliefs in God, for example, will fall into this category.  The evidentialist atheist and the non-evidentialist theist, therefore, may have a number of more fundamental disagreements about the acceptability of believing, despite inadequate or contrary evidence, the epistemological status of prudential grounds for believing, or the nature of God belief.  Their disagreement may not be so much about the evidence, or even about God, but about the legitimate roles that evidence, reason, and faith should play in human belief structures.

It is not clear that arguments against atheism that appeal to faith have any prescriptive force the way appeals to evidence do.  The general evidentialist view is that when a person grasps that an argument is sound that imposes an epistemic obligation on her to accept the conclusion.  Insofar as having faith that a claim is true amounts to believing contrary to or despite a lack of evidence, one person’s faith that God exists does not have this sort of inter-subjective, epistemological implication.  Failing to believe what is clearly supported by the evidence is ordinarily irrational.  Failure to have faith that some claim is true is not similarly culpable.

Justifying atheism, then, can entail several different projects.  There are the evidential disputes over what information we have available to us, how it should be interpreted, and what it implies.  There are also broader meta-epistemological concerns about the roles of argument, reasoning, belief, and religiousness in human life.  The atheist can find herself not just arguing that the evidence indicates that there is no God, but defending science, the role of reason, and the necessity of basing beliefs on evidence more generally.

Friendly atheism; William Rowe has introduced an important distinction to modern discussions of atheism. If someone has arrived at what they take to be a reasonable and well-justified conclusion that there is no God, then what attitude should she take about another person’s persistence in believing in God, particularly when that other person appears to be thoughtful and at least prima facie reasonable?  It seems that the atheist could take one of several views.  The theist’s belief, as the atheist sees it, could be rational or irrational, justified or unjustified.  Must the atheist who believes that the evidence indicates that there is no God conclude that the theist’s believing in God is irrational or unjustified?  Rowe’s answer is no.  (Rowe 1979, 2006)

Rowe and most modern epistemologists have said that whether a conclusion C is justified for a person  S is a function of the information (correct or incorrect) that S possesses and the principles of inference that S employs in arriving at C.  But whether or not C is justified is not directly tied to its truth, or even to the truth of the evidence concerning C.  That is, a person can have a justified, but false belief.  She could arrive at a conclusion through an epistemically inculpable process and yet get it wrong.  Ptolemy, for example, the greatest astronomer of his day, who had mastered all of the available information and conducted exhaustive research into the question, was justified in concluding that the Sun orbits the Earth.  A medieval physician in the 1200s who guesses (correctly) that the bubonic plague was caused by the bacterium yersinia pestis would not have been reasonable or justified given his background information and given that the bacterium would not even be discovered for 600 years.

We can call the view that rational, justified beliefs can be false, as it applies to atheism, friendly or fallibilist atheism.  See the article on Fallibilism. The friendly atheist can grant that a theist may be justified or reasonable in believing in God, even though the atheist takes the theist’s conclusion to be false.  What could explain their divergence to the atheist?  The believer may not be in possession of all of the relevant information.  The believer may be basing her conclusion on a false premise or premises.  The believer may be implicitly or explicitly employing inference rules that themselves are not reliable or truth preserving, but the background information she has leads her, reasonably, to trust the inference rule.  The same points can be made for the friendly theist and the view that he may take about the reasonableness of the atheist’s conclusion.  It is also possible, of course, for both sides to be unfriendly and conclude that anyone who disagrees with what they take to be justified is being irrational.  Given developments in modern epistemology and Rowe’s argument, however, the unfriendly view is neither correct nor conducive to a constructive and informed analysis of the question of God.

Atheists have offered a wide range of justifications and accounts for non-belief.  A notable modern view is Antony Flew’s Presumption of Atheism (1984). Flew argues that the default position for any rational believer should be neutral with regard to the existence of God and to be neutral is to not have a belief regarding its existence.  And not having a belief with regard to God is to be a negative atheist on Flew’s account. “The onus of proof lies on the man who affirms, not on the man who denies. . . on the proposition, not on the opposition,” Flew argues (20).  Beyond that, coming to believe that such a thing does or does not exist will require justification, much as a jury presumes innocence concerning the accused and requires evidence in order to conclude that he is guilty.  Flew’s negative atheist will presume nothing at the outset, not even the logical coherence of the notion of God, but her presumption is defeasible, or revisable in the light of evidence.  We shall call this view atheism by default.

The atheism by default position contrasts with a more permissive attitude that is sometimes taken regarding religious belief.  The notions of religious tolerance and freedom are sometimes understood to indicate the epistemic permissibility of believing despite a lack of evidence in favor or even despite evidence to the contrary.  One is in violation of no epistemic duty by believing, even if one lacks conclusive evidence in favor or even if one has evidence that is on the whole against.  In contrast to Flew’s jury model, we can think of this view as treating religious beliefs as permissible until proven incorrect.  Some aspects of fideistic accounts or Plantinga’s reformed epistemology can be understood in this light.  This sort of epistemic policy about God or any other matter has been controversial, and a major point of contention between atheists and theists.  Atheists have argued that we typically do not take it to be epistemically inculpable or reasonable for a person to believe in Santa Claus, the Tooth Fairy, or some other supernatural being merely because they do not possess evidence to the contrary.  Nor would we consider it reasonable for a person to begin believing that they have cancer because they do not have proof to the contrary.  The atheist by default argues that it would be appropriate to not believe in such circumstances.  The epistemic policy here takes its inspiration from an influential piece by W.K. Clifford (1999) in which he argues that it is wrong, always, everywhere, and for anyone, to believe anything for which there is insufficient reason.

There are several other approaches to the justification of atheism that we will consider below.  There is a family of arguments, sometimes known as exercises in deductive atheology, for the conclusion that the existence of God is impossible.  Another large group of important and influential arguments can be gathered under the heading inductive atheology.  These probabilistic arguments invoke considerations about the natural world such as widespread suffering, nonbelief, or findings from biology or cosmology.  Another approach, atheistic noncognitivism, denies that God talk is even meaningful or has any propositional content that can be evaluated in terms of truth or falsity. Rather, religious speech acts are better viewed as a complicated sort of emoting or expression of spiritual passion.  Inductive and deductive approaches are cognitivistic in that they accept that claims about God have meaningful content and can be determined to be true or false.

3. Deductive Atheology

Many discussions about the nature and existence of God have either implicitly or explicitly accepted that the concept of God is logically coherent.  That is, for many believers and non-believers the assumption has been that such a being as God could possibly exist but they have disagreed about whether there actually is one.  Atheists within the deductive atheology tradition, however, have not even granted that God, as he is typically described, is possible.  The first question we should ask, argues the deductive atheist, is whether the description or the concept is logically consistent.  If it is not, then no such being could possibly exist.  The deductive atheist argues that some, one, or all of God’s essential properties are logically contradictory.  Since logical impossibilities are not and cannot be real, God does not and cannot exist.  Consider a putative description of an object as a four-sided triangle, a married bachelor, or prime number with more than 2 factors.  We can be certain that no such thing fitting that description exists because what they describe is demonstrably impossible.

If deductive atheological proofs are successful, the results are epistemically significant.  Many people have doubts that the view that there is no God can be rationally justified.  But if deductive disproofs show that there can exist no being with a certain property or properties and those properties figure essentially in the characterization of God, then we will have the strongest possible justification for concluding that there is no being fitting any of those characterizations.  If God is impossible, then God does not exist.

It may be possible at this point to re-engineer the description of God so that it avoids the difficulties, but as a consequence the theist faces several challenges according to the deductive atheologist.  First, if the traditional description of God is logically incoherent, then what is the relationship between a theist’s belief and some revised, more sophisticated account that allegedly does not suffer from those problems? Is that the God that she believed in all along?  Before the account of God was improved by consideration of the atheological arguments, what were the reasons that led her to believe in that conception of God?  Secondly, if the classical characterizations of God are shown to be logically impossible, then there is a legitimate question as whether any new description that avoids those problems describes a being that is worthy of the label.  It will not do, in the eyes of many theists and atheists, to retreat to the view that God is merely a somewhat powerful, partially-knowing, and partly-good being, for example.  Thirdly, the atheist will still want to know on the basis of what evidence or arguments should we conclude that a being as described by this modified account exists?  Fourthly, there is no question that there exist less than omni-beings in the world.  We possess less than infinite power, knowledge and goodness, as do many other creatures and objects in our experience.  What is the philosophical importance or metaphysical significance of arguing for the existence of those sorts of beings and advocating belief in them?  Fifthly, and most importantly, if it has been argued that God’s essential properties are impossible, then any move to another description seems to be a concession that positive atheism about God is justified.

Another possible response that the theist may take in response to deductive atheological arguments is to assert that God is something beyond proper description with any of the concepts or properties that we can or do employ as suggested in Kierkegaard or Tillich.  So complications from incompatibilities among properties of God indicate problems for our descriptions, not the impossibility of a divine being worthy of the label. Many atheists have not been satisfied with this response because the theist has now asserted the existence of and attempted to argue in favor of believing in a being that we cannot form a proper idea of, one that does not have  properties that we can acknowledge; it is a being that defies comprehension.  It is not clear how we could have reasons or justifications for believing in the existence of such a thing.  It is not clear how it could be an existing thing in any familiar sense of the term in that it lacks comprehensible properties.  Or put another way, as Patrick Grim notes, “If a believer’s notion of God remains so vague as to escape all impossibility arguments, it can be argued, it cannot be clear to even him what he believes—or whether what he takes for pious belief has any content at all,” (2007, p. 200).  It is not clear how it could be reasonable to believe in such a thing, and it is even more doubtful that it is epistemically unjustified or irresponsible to deny that such a thing is exists.  It is clear, however, that the deductive atheologist must acknowledge the growth and development of our concepts and descriptions of reality over time, and she must take a reasonable view about the relationship of those attempts and revisions in our ideas about what may turns out to be real.

a. Single Property Disproofs

Deductive disproofs have typically focused on logical inconsistencies to be found either within a single property or between multiple properties.  Philosophers have struggled to work out the details of what it would be to be omnipotent, for instance.  It has come to be widely accepted that a being cannot be omnipotent where omnipotence simply means to power to do anything including the logically impossible.  This definition of the term suffers from the stone paradox.  An omnipotent being would either be capable of creating a rock that he cannot lift, or he is incapable.  If he is incapable, then there is something he cannot do, and therefore he does not have the power to do anything.  If he can create such a rock, then again there is something that he cannot do, namely lift the rock he just created.  So paradoxically, having the ability to do anything would appear to entail being unable to do some things.  As a result, many theists and atheists have agreed that a being could not have that property.  A number of attempts to work out an account of omnipotence have ensued.  (Cowan 2003, Flint and Freddoso 1983, Hoffman and Rosenkrantz 1988 and 2006, Mavrodes 1977, Ramsey 1956, Sobel 2004, Savage 1967, and Wierenga 1989 for examples).  It has also been argued that omniscience is impossible, and that the most knowledge that can possibly be had is not enough to be fitting of God.  One of the central problems has been that God cannot have knowledge of indexical claims such as, “I am here now.”  It has also been argued that God cannot know future free choices, or God cannot know future contingent propositions, or that Cantor’s and Gödel proofs imply that the notion of a set of all truths cannot be made coherent.  (Everitt 2004, Grim 1985, 1988, 1984, Pucetti 1963, and Sobel 2004).  See the article on Omniscience and Divine Foreknowledge for more details.

The logical coherence of eternality, personhood, moral perfection, causal agency, and many others have been challenged in the deductive atheology literature.

b. Multiple Property Disproofs

Another form of deductive atheological argument attempts to show the logical incompatibility of two or more properties that God is thought to possess.  A long list of properties have been the subject of multiple property disproofs, transcendence and personhood, justice and mercy, immutability and omniscience, immutability and omnibenevolence, omnipresence and agency, perfection and love, eternality and omniscience, eternality and creator of the universe, omnipresence and consciousness.   (Blumenfeld 2003, Drange 1998b, Flew 1955, Grim 2007, Kretzmann 1966, and McCormick 2000 and 2003)

The combination of omnipotence and omniscience have received a great deal of attention.  To possess all knowledge, for instance, would include knowing all of the particular ways in which one will exercise one’s power, or all of the decisions that one will make, or all of the decisions that one has made in the past.  But knowing any of those entails that the known proposition is true.  So does God have the power to act in some fashion that he has not foreseen, or differently than he already has without compromising his omniscience?  It has also been argued that God cannot be both unsurpassably good and free.  (Rowe 2004).

c. Failure of Proof Disproof

When attempts to provide evidence or arguments in favor of the existence of something fail, a legitimate and important question is whether anything except the failure of those arguments can be inferred.  That is, does positive atheism follow from the failure of arguments for theism?  A number of authors have concluded that it does.  They taken the view that unless some case for the existence of God succeeds, we should believe that there is no God.

Many have taken an argument J.M. Findlay (1948) to be pivotal.  Findlay, like many others, argues that in order to be worthy of the label “God,” and in order to be worthy of a worshipful attitude of reverence, emulation, and abandoned admiration, the being that is the object of that attitude must be inescapable, necessary, and unsurpassably supreme.  (Martin 1990, Sobel 2004).  If a being like God were to exist, his existence would be necessary.  And his existence would be manifest as an a priori, conceptual truth.  That is to say that of all the approaches to God’s existence, the ontological argument is the strategy that we would expect to be successful were there a God, and if they do not succeed, then we can conclude that there is no God, Findlay argues. As most see it these attempts to prove God have not met with success, Findlay says, “The general philosophical verdict is that none of these ‘proofs’ is truly compelling.”

4. Inductive Atheology

a. The Prospects for Inductive Proof

The view that there is no God or gods has been criticized on the grounds that it is not possible to prove a negative.  No matter how exhaustive and careful our analysis, there could always be some proof, some piece of evidence, or some consideration that we have not considered.  God could be something that we have not conceived, or God exists in some form or fashion that has escaped our investigation.  Positive atheism draws a stronger conclusion than any of the problems with arguments for God’s existence alone could justify.  Absence of evidence is not evidence of absence.

Findlay and the deductive atheological arguments attempt to address these concerns, but a central question put to atheists has been about the possibility of giving inductive or probabilistic justifications for negative existential claims.  The response to the, “You cannot prove a negative” criticism has been that it invokes an artificially high epistemological standard of justification that creates a much broader set of problems not confined to atheism.

The general principle seems to be that one is not epistemically entitled to believe a proposition unless you have exhausted all of the possibilities and proven beyond any doubt that a claim is true.  Or put negatively, one is not justified in disbelieving unless you have proven with absolute certainty that the thing in question does not exist.  The problem is that we do not have a priori disproof that many things do not exist, yet it is reasonable and justified to believe that they do not:  the Dodo bird is extinct, unicorns are not real, there is no teapot orbiting the Earth on the opposite side of the Sun, there is no Santa Claus, ghosts are not real, a defendant is not guilty, a patient does not have a particular disease, so on.  There are a wide range of other circumstances under which we take it that believing that X does not exist is reasonable even though no logical impossibility is manifest. None of these achieve the level of deductive, a priori or conceptual proof.

The objection to inductive atheism undermines itself in that it generates a broad, pernicious skepticism against far more than religious or irreligious beliefs.  Mackie (1982) says, “It will not be sufficient to criticize each argument on its own by saying that it does not prove the intended conclusion, that is, does not put it beyond all doubt.  That follows at once from the admission that the argument is non-deductive, and it is absurd to try to confine our knowledge and belief to matters which are conclusively established by sound deductive arguments.  The demand for certainty will inevitably be disappointed, leaving skepticism in command of almost every issue”  (p. 7).  If the atheist is unjustified for lacking deductive proof, then it is argued, it would appear that so are the beliefs that planes fly, fish swim, or that there exists a mind-independent world.

The atheist can also wonder what the point of the objection is.  When we lack deductive disproof that X exists, should we be agnostic about it?  Is it permissible to believe that it does exist?  Clearly, that would not be appropriate.  Gravity may be the work of invisible, undetectable elves with sticky shoes.  We don’t have any certain disproof of the elves—physicists are still struggling with an explanation of gravity.  But surely someone who accepts the sticky-shoed elves view until they have deductive disproof is being unreasonable.  It is also clear that if you are a positive atheist about the gravity elves, you would not be unreasonable.  You would not be overstepping your epistemic entitlement by believing that no such things exist.  On the contrary, believing that they exist or even being agnostic about their existence on the basis of their mere possibility would not be justified.  So there appear to be a number of precedents and epistemic principles at work in our belief structures that provide room for inductive atheism.  However, these issues in the epistemology of atheism and recent work by Graham Oppy (2006) suggest that more attention must be paid to the principles that describe epistemic  permissibility, culpability, reasonableness, and justification with regard to the theist, atheist, and agnostic categories.

Below we will consider several groups of influential inductive atheological arguments .

b. The Santa Claus Argument

Martin (1990) offers this general principle to describe the criteria that render the belief, “X does not exist” justified:

A person is justified in believing that X does not exist if

(1)  all the available evidence used to support the view that X exists is shown to be inadequate; and

(2)  X is the sort of entity that, if X exists, then there is a presumption that would be evidence adequate to support the view that X exists; and

(3)  this presumption has not been defeated although serious efforts have been made to do so; and

(4)  the area where evidence would appear, if there were any, has been comprehensively examined; and

(5)  there are no acceptable beneficial reasons to believe that X exists.  (p. 283)

Many of the major works in philosophical atheism that address the full range of recent arguments for God’s existence (Gale 1991, Mackie 1982, Martin 1990, Sobel 2004, Everitt 2004, and Weisberger 1999) can be seen as providing evidence to satisfy the first,  fourth and fifth conditions.  A substantial body of articles with narrower scope (see References and Further Reading) can also be understood to play this role in justifying atheism.  A large group of discussions of Pascal’s Wager and related prudential justifications in the literature can also be seen as relevant to the satisfaction of the fifth condition.

One of the interesting and important questions in the epistemology of philosophy of religion has been whether the second and third conditions are satisfied concerning God.  If there were a God, how and in what ways would we expect him to show in the world?  Empirically?  Conceptually?  Would he be hidden?  Martin argues, and many others have accepted implicitly or explicitly, that God is the sort of thing that would manifest in some discernible fashion to our inquiries.   Martin concludes, therefore, that God satisfied all of the conditions, so, positive narrow atheism is justified.

c. Problem of Evil

The existence of widespread human and non-human animal suffering has been seen by many to be compelling evidence that a being with all power, all knowledge, and all goodness does not exist.  Many of those arguments have been deductive:  See the article on The Logical Problem of Evil. In the 21st century, several inductive arguments from evil for the non-existence of God have received a great deal of attention.  See The Evidential Problem of Evil.

d. Cosmology

Questions about the origins of the universe and cosmology have been the focus for many inductive atheism arguments.  We can distinguish four recent views about God and the cosmos:

Naturalism: On naturalistic view, the Big Bang occurred approximately 13.7 billion years ago, the Earth formed out of cosmic matter about 4.6 billion years ago, and life forms on Earth, unaided by any supernatural forces about 4 billion years ago.  Various physical (non-God) hypotheses are currently being explored about the cause or explanation of the Big Bang such as the Hartle-Hawking no-boundary condition model, brane cosmology models, string theoretic models, ekpyrotic models, cyclic models, chaotic inflation, and so on.

Big Bang Theism: We can call the view that God caused about the Big Bang 13.7 billion years ago Big Bang Theism.

Intelligent Design Theism: There are many variations, but most often the view is that God created the universe, perhaps with the Big Bang 13.7 billion years ago, and then beginning with the appearance of life 4 billion years ago.  God supernaturally guided the formation and development of life into the forms we see today.

Creationism: Finally, there is a group of people who for the most part denies the occurrence of the Big Bang and of evolution altogether; God created the universe, the Earth, and all of the life on Earth in its more or less present form 6,000-10,000 years ago.

Taking a broad view, many atheists have concluded that neither Big Bang Theism, Intelligent Design Theism, nor Creationism is the most reasonable description of the history of the universe.  Before the theory of evolution and recent developments in modern astronomy, a view wherein God did not play a large role in the creation and unfolding of the cosmos would have been hard to justify.  Now, internal problems with those views and the evidence from cosmology and biology indicate that naturalism is the best explanation.  Justifications for Big Bang Theism have focused on modern versions of the Cosmological and Kalam arguments.  Since everything that comes into being must have a cause, including the universe, then God was the cause of the Big Bang. (Craig 1995)

The objections to these arguments have been numerous and vigorously argued.  Critics have challenged the inference to a supernatural cause to fill gaps in the natural account, as well as the inferences that the first cause must be a single, personal, all-powerful, all-knowing, and all-good being.  It is not clear that any of the properties of God as classically conceived in orthodox monotheism can be inferred from what we know about the Big Bang without first accepting a number of theistic assumptions.  Infinite power and knowledge do not appear to be required to bring about a Big Bang—what if our Big Bang was the only act that a being could perform?  There appears to be consensus that infinite goodness or moral perfection cannot be inferred as a necessary part of the cause of the Big Bang—theists have focused their efforts in the problem of evil, discussions just attempting to prove that it is possible that God is infinitely good given the state of the world.  Big Bang Theism would need to show that no other sort of cause besides a morally perfect one could explain the universe we find ourselves in.  Critics have also doubted whether we can know that some supernatural force that caused the Big Bang is still in existence or is the same entity as identified and worshipped in any particular religious tradition.  Even if major concessions are granted in the cosmological argument, all that it would seem to suggest is that there was a first cause or causes, but widely accepted arguments from that first cause or causes to the fully articulated God of Christianity or Islam, for instance, have not been forthcoming.

In some cases, atheists have taken the argument a step further.  They have offered cosmological arguments for the nonexistence of God on the basis of considerations from physics, astronomy, and subatomic theory.  These arguments are quite technical, so they are given brief attention.  God, if he exists, knowing all and having all power, would only employ those means to his ends that are rational, effective, efficient, and optimal.  If God were the creator, then he was the cause of the Big Bang, but cosmological atheists have argued that the singularity that produced the Big Bang and events that unfold thereafter preclude a rational divine agent from achieving particular ends with the Big Bang as the means.  The Big Bang would not have been the route God would have chosen to this world as a result.  (Stenger 2007, Smith 1993, Everitt 2004.)

e. Teleological Arguments

In William Paley’s famous analysis, he argues by analogy that the presence of order in the universe, like the features we find in a watch, are indicative of the existence of a designer who is responsible for the artifact.  Many authors—David Hume (1935), Wesley Salmon (1978), Michael Martin (1990)—have argued that a better case can be made for the nonexistence of God from the evidence.

Salmon, giving a modern Bayesian version of an argument that begins with Hume, argues that the likelihood that the ordered universe was created by intelligence is very low.  In general, instances of biologically or mechanically caused generation without intelligence are far more common than instances of creation from intelligence.  Furthermore, the probability that something that is generated by a biological or mechanical cause will exhibit order is quite high.  Among those things that are designed, the probability that they exhibit order may be quite high, but that is not the same as asserting that among the things that exhibit order the probability that they were designed is high.  Among dogs, the incidence of fur may be high, but it is not true that among furred things the incidence of dogs is high.  Furthermore, intelligent design and careful planning very frequently produces disorder—war, industrial pollution, insecticides, and so on.

So we can conclude that the probability that an unspecified entity (like the universe), which came into being and exhibits order, was produced by intelligent design is very low and that the empirical evidence indicates that there was no designer.

See the article on Design Arguments for the Existence of God for more details about the history of the argument and standard objections that have motivated atheism.

f. Arguments from Nonbelief

Another recent group of inductive atheistic arguments has focused on widespread nonbelief itself as evidence that atheism is justified.  The common thread in these arguments is that something as significant in the universe as God could hardly be overlooked.  The ultimate creator of the universe and a being with infinite knowledge, power, and love would not escape our attention, particularly since humans have devoted such staggering amounts of energy to the question for so many centuries.   Perhaps more importantly, a being such as God, if he chose, could certainly make his existence manifest to us.  Creating a state of affairs where his existence would be obvious, justified, or reasonable to us, or at least more obvious to more of us than it is currently, would be a trivial matter for an all-powerful being. So since our efforts have not yielded what we would expect to find if there were a God, then the most plausible explanation is that there is no God.

One might argue that we should not assume that God’s existence would be evident to us.  There may be reasons, some of which we can describe, others that we do not understand, that God could have for remaining out of sight.   Revealing himself is not something he desires, remaining hidden enables people to freely love, trust and obey him, remaining hidden prevents humans from reacting from improper motives, like fear of punishment, remaining hidden preserves human freewill.

The non-belief atheist has not found these speculations convincing for several reasons.  In religious history, God’s revealing himself to Moses, Muhammad, Jesus’ disciples, and even Satan himself did not compromise their cognitive freedom in any significant way.  Furthermore, attempts to explain why a universe where God exists would look just as we would expect a universe with no God have seemed ad hoc.  Some of the logical positivists’ and non-cognitivists’ concerns surface here.  If the believer maintains that a universe inhabited by God will look exactly like one without, then we must wonder what sort of counter-evidence would be allowed, even in principle, against the theist’s claim.  If no state of affairs could be construed as evidence against God’s existence, then what does the claim, “God exists,” mean and what are its real implications?

Alternately, how can it be unreasonable to not believe in the existence of something that defies all of our attempts to corroborate or discover?

Theodore Drange (2006)  has developed an argument that if God were the sort of being that wanted humans to come to believe that he exists, then he could bring it about that far more of them would believe than currently do.  God would be able, he would want humans to believe, there is nothing that he would want more, and God would not be irrational.  So God would bring it about that people would believe.  In general, he could have brought it about that the evidence that people have is far more convincing than what they have.  He could have miraculously appeared to everyone in a fashion that was far more compelling than the miracles stories that we have.  It is not the case that all, nearly all, or even a majority of people believe, so there must not be a God of that sort.

J.L. Schellenberg (1993) has developed an argument based upon a number of considerations that lead us to think that if there were a loving God, then we would expect to find some manifestations of him in the world.  If God is all powerful, then there would be nothing restraining him from making his presence known.  And if he is omniscient, then surely he would know how to reveal himself.  Perhaps, most importantly, if God is good and if God possesses an unsurpassable love for us, then God would consider each human’s requests as important and seek to respond quickly.  He would wish to spare those that he loves needless trauma.  He would not want to give those that he loves false or misleading thoughts about his relationship to them.  He would want as much personal interaction with them as possible, but of course, these conditions are not satisfied.  So it is strongly indicated that there is no such God.

Schellenberg gives this telling parable:

“You’re still a small child, and an amnesiac, but this time you’re in the middle of a vast rain forest, dripping with dangers of various kinds.  You’ve been stuck there for days, trying to figure out who you are and where you came from.  You don’t remember having a mother who accompanied you into this jungle, but in your moments of deepest pain and misery you call for her anyway, ‘Mooooommmmmmm!’  Over and over again.  For days and days … the last time when a jaguar comes at you out of nowhere … but with no response.  What should you think in this situation?  In your dying moments, what should cross your mind?  Would the thought that you have a mother who cares about you and hears your cry and could come to you but chooses not to even make it onto the list?” (2006, p. 31)

Like Drange, Schellenberg argues that there are many people who are epistemically inculpable in believing that there is no God.  That is, many people have carefully considered the evidence available to them, and have actively sought out more in order to determine what is reasonable concerning God.  They have fulfilled all relevant epistemic duties they might have in their inquiry into the question and they have arrived at a justified belief that there is no God.  If there were a God, however, evidence sufficient to form a reasonable belief in his existence would be available. So the occurrence of widespread epistemically inculpable nonbelief itself shows that there is no God.

g. Atheistic Naturalism

The final family of inductive arguments we will consider involves drawing a positive atheistic conclusion from broad, naturalized grounds.  See the article on Naturalism for background about the position and relevant arguments.  Comments here will be confined to naturalism as it relates to atheism.

Methodological naturalism can be understood as the view that the best or the only way to acquire knowledge within science is by adopting the assumption that all physical phenomena have physical causes.  This presumption by itself does not commit one to the view that only physical entities and causes exist, or that all knowledge must be acquired through scientific methods.  Methodological naturalism, therefore, is typically not seen as being in direct conflict with theism or having any particular implications for the existence or non-existence of God.

Ontological naturalism, however, is usually seen as taking a stronger view about the existence of God.  Ontological naturalism is the additional view that all and only physical entities and causes exist.

Among its theistic critics, there has been a tendency to portray ontological naturalism as a dogmatic ideological commitment that is more the product of a recent intellectual fashion than science or reasoned argument.  But two developments have contributed to a broad argument in favor of ontological naturalism as the correct description of what sorts of things exist and are causally efficacious.  First, there is a substantial history of the exploration and rejection of a variety of non-physical causal hypotheses in the history of science.  Over the centuries, the possibility that some class of physical events could be caused by a supernatural source, a spiritual source, psychic energy, mental forces, or vital causes have been entertained and found wanting.  Second, evidence for the law of the conservation of energy has provided significant support to physical closure, or the view that the natural world is a complete closed system in which physical events have physical causes.  At the very least, atheists have argued, the ruins of so many supernatural explanations that have been found wanting in the history of science has created an enormous burden of proof that must be met before any claim about the existence of another worldly spiritual being can have credence.  Ontological naturalism should not be seen as a dogmatic commitment, its defenders have insisted, but rather as a defeasible hypothesis that is supported by centuries of inquiry into the supernatural.

As scientific explanations have expanded to include more details about the workings of natural objects and laws, there has been less and less room or need for invoking God as an explanation.  It is not clear that expansion of scientific knowledge disproves the existence of God in any formal sense any more than it has disproven the existence of fairies, the atheistic naturalist argues.  However, physical explanations have increasingly rendered God explanations extraneous and anomalous.  For example, when Laplace, the famous 18^th century French mathematician and astronomer, presented his work on celestial mechanics to Napoleon, the Emperor asked him about the role of a divine creator in his system Laplace is reported to have said, “I have no need for that hypothesis.”

In many cases, science has shown that particular ancillary theses of traditional religious doctrine are mistaken.  Blind, petitionary prayer has been investigated and found to have no effect on the health of its recipients, although praying itself may have some positive effects on the person who prayers (Benson, 2006).  Geology, biology, and cosmology have discovered that the Earth formed approximately 3 billion years ago out of cosmic dust, and life evolved gradually over billions of years.  The Earth, humans, and other life forms were not created in their present form some 6,000-10,000 years ago and the atheistic naturalist will point to numerous  alleged miraculous events have been investigated and debunked.

Wide, positive atheism, the view that there are no gods whatsoever, might appear to be the most difficult atheistic thesis to defend, but ontological naturalists have responded that the case for no gods is parallel to the case for no elves, pixies, dwarves, fairies, goblins, or other creates.  A decisive proof against every possible supernatural being is not necessary for the conclusion that none of them are real to be justified.  The ontological naturalist atheist believes that once we have devoted sufficient investigation into enough particular cases and the general considerations about natural laws, magic, and supernatural entities, it becomes reasonable to conclude that the whole enterprise is an explanatory dead end for figuring out what sort of things there are in the world.

The disagreement between atheists and theists continues on two fronts.  Within the arena of science and the natural world, some believers have persisted in arguing that material explanations are inadequate to explain all of the particular events and phenomena that we observe.  Some philosophers and scientists have argued that for phenomena like consciousness, human morality, and some instances of biological complexity, explanations in terms of natural or evolutionary theses have not and will not be able to provide us with a complete picture.  Therefore, the inference to some supernatural force is warranted.  While some of these attempts have received social and political support, within the scientific community the arguments that causal closure is false and that God as a cause is a superior scientific hypothesis to naturalistic explanations have not received significant support.  Science can cite a history of replacing spiritual, supernatural, or divine explanations of phenomena with natural ones from bad weather as the wrath of angry gods to disease as demon possession.  The assumption for many is that there are no substantial reasons to doubt that those areas of the natural world that have not been adequately explained scientifically will be given enough time.  ( Madden and Hare 1968, Papineau, Manson, Nielsen 2001, and Stenger.)  Increasingly, with what they perceive as the failure of attempts to justify theism, atheists have moved towards naturalized accounts of religious belief that give causal and evolutionary explanations of the prevalence of belief.  (See Atrans, Boyer, Dennett 2006)

5. Cognitivism and Non-Cognitivism

In 20^th century moral theory, a view about the nature of moral value claims arose that has an analogue in discussions of atheism.  Moral non-cognitivists have denied that moral utterances should be treated as ordinary propositions that are either true or false and subject to evidential analysis.  On their view, when someone makes a moral claim like, “Cheating is wrong,” what they are doing is more akin to saying something like, “I have negative feelings about cheating.  I want you to share those negative feelings.  Cheating.  Bad.”

A non-cognitivist atheist denies that religious utterances are propositions.  They are not the sort of speech act that have a truth value.  They are more like emoting, singing, poetry, or cheering.  They express personal desires, feelings of subjugation, admiration, humility, and love.  As such, they cannot and should not be dealt with by denials or arguments any more than I can argue with you over whether or not a poem moves you.  There is an appeal to this approach when we consider common religious utterances such as, “Jesus loves you.”  “Jesus died for your sins.”  “God be with you.”  What these mean, according to the non-cognitivist, is something like, “I have sympathy for your plight, we are all in a similar situation and in need of paternalistic comforting, you can have it if you perform certain kinds of behaviors and adopt a certain kind of personal posture with regard to your place in the world.  When I do these things I feel joyful, I want you to feel joyful too.”

So the non-cognitivist atheist does not claim that the sentence, “God exists” is false, as such.  Rather, when people make these sorts of claims, their behavior is best understood as a complicated publicizing of a particular sort of subjective sensations.  Strictly speaking, the claims do not mean anything in terms of assertions about what sorts of entities do or do not exist in the world independent of human cognitive and emotional states.  The non-cognitivist characterization of many religious speech acts and behaviors has seemed to some to be the most accurate description.  For the most part, atheists appear to be cognitivist atheists.  They assume that religious utterances do express propositions that are either true or false.  Positive atheists will argue that there are compelling reasons or evidence for concluding that in fact those claims are false.  (Drange 2006, Diamond and Lizenbury 1975, Nielsen 1985)

Few would disagree that many religious utterances are non-cognitive such as religious ceremonies, rituals, and liturgies.   Non-cognitivists have argued that many believers are confused when their speech acts and behavior slips from being non-cognitive to something resembling cognitive assertions about God.  The problem with the non-cognitivist view is that many religious utterances are clearly treated as cognitive by their speakers—they are meant to be treated as true or false claims, they are treated as making a difference, and they clearly have an impact on people’s lives and beliefs beyond the mere expression of a special category of emotions.  Insisting that those claims simply have no cognitive content despite the intentions and arguments to the contrary of the speaker is an ineffectual means of addressing them.  So non-cognitivism does not appear to completely address belief in God.

6. Future Prospects for Atheism

20^th century developments in epistemology, philosophy of science, logic, and philosophy of language indicate that many of the presumptions that supported old fashioned natural theology and atheology are mistaken.  It appears that even our most abstract, a priori, and deductively certain methods for determining truth are subject to revision in the light of empirical discoveries and theoretical analyses of the principles that underlie those methods.  Certainty, reasoning, and theology, after Bayes’ work on probability, Wittgenstein’s fideism, Quine’s naturalism, and Kripke’s work on necessity are not what they used to be.  The prospects for a simple, confined argument for atheism (or theism) that achieves widespread support or that settles the question are dim.  That is because, in part, the prospects for any argument that decisively settles a philosophical question where a great deal seems to be at stake are dim.

The existence or non-existence of any non-observable entity in the world is not settled by any single argument or consideration.  Every premise is based upon other concepts and principles that themselves must be justified.  So ultimately, the adequacy of atheism as an explanatory hypothesis about what is real will depend upon the overall coherence, internal consistency, empirical confirmation, and explanatory success of a whole worldview within which atheism is only one small part.  The question of whether or not there is a God sprawls onto related issues and positions about biology, physics, metaphysics, explanation, philosophy of science, ethics, philosophy of language, and epistemology.  The reasonableness of atheism depends upon the overall adequacy of a whole conceptual and explanatory description of the world.

7. References and Further Reading

• Atran, Scott, 2002,  In Gods We Trust:  The Evolutionary Landscape of Religion. New York:  Oxford University Press.
  • An evolutionary and anthropological account of religious beliefs and institutions.
• Benson H, Dusek JA, Sherwood JB, Lam P, Bethea CF, Carpenter W, Levitsky S, Hill PC, Clem DW Jr, Jain MK, Drumel D,Kopecky SL, Mueller PS, Marek D, Rollins S, Hibberd PL. “Study of the Therapeutic Effects of Intercessory Prayer (STEP) in cardiac bypass patients: a multicenter randomized trial of uncertainty and certainty of receiving intercessory prayer.” American Heart Journal, April 2006 151(4):934-42.
• Blumenfeld, David, 2003,  “On the Compossibility of the Divine Attributes,”  In The Impossibility of God. eds, Martin and Monnier. Amherst, N.Y.:  Prometheus Press.
  • The implications of perfection show that God’s power, knowledge, and goodness are not compatible, so the standard Judeo-Christian divine and perfect being is impossible.
• Boyer, Pascal 2001, Religion Explained: The Evolutionary Origins of Religious Thought.  New York:  Basic Books.
  • An influential anthropological and evolutionary work.  Religion exists to sustain important aspects of social psychology.
• Clifford, W.K., 1999, “The Ethics of Belief,”  in The Ethics of Belief and other Essays. Amherst, NY: Prometheus Books.
  • Famously, Clifford argues that it is wrong always and anywhere to believe anything on the basis of insufficient evidence.  Important and influential argument in discussions of atheism and faith.
• Cowan, J. L., 2003,  “The Paradox of Omnipotence,” In The Impossibility of God. eds, Martin and Monnier. Amherst, N.Y.:  Prometheus Press.
  • No being can have the power to do everything that is not self-contradictory.  That God has that sort of omnipotence is itself self-contradictory.
• Craig, William L. and Quentin Smith 1995.  Theism, Atheism, and Big Bang Cosmology. N.Y.: Oxford University Press.
  • Craig and Smith have an exchange on the cosmological evidence in favor of theism, for atheism, and Hawking’s quantum cosmology.  The work is part of an important recent shift that takes the products of scientific investigation to be directly relevant to the question of God’s existence.
• Darwin, Charles,  1871.  The Descent of Man, and the Selection in Relation to Sex. London:  John Murray.
  • Twelve years after The Origin of Species, Darwin makes a thorough and compelling case for the evolution of humans.  He also expands on numerous details of the theory.
• Darwin, Charles, 1859.  The Origin of Species by Means of Natural Selection. London:  John Murray.
  • Darwin’s first book where he explains his theory of natural selection.  No explicit mention of humans is made, but the theological implications are clear for the teleological argument.
• Dennett, Daniel, 2006.  Breaking the Spell:  Religion as a Natural Phenomenon. New York:  Viking Penguin.
  • Important work among the so-called New Atheists.  Dennett argues that religion can and should be studying by science.  He outlines evolutionary explanations for religion’s cultural and psychological influence.
• Diamond, Malcolm L. and Lizenbury, Thomas V. Jr. (eds)  The Logic of God, Indianapolis, Ind.:  Bobbs-Merrill, 1975.
  • A collection of articles addressing the logical coherence of the properties of God.
• Drange, Theodore, 1998a.  Nonbelief and Evil. Amherst, N.Y.:  Prometheus Books.
  • Drange gives an argument from evil against the existence of the God of evangelical Christianity, and an argument that the God of evangelical Christianity could and would bring about widespread belief, therefore such a God does not exist.
• Drange, Theodore, 1998b.  “Incompatible Properties Arguments:  A Survey.”  Philo 1: 2.  pp. 49-60.
  • A useful discussion of several property pairs that are not logically compatible in the same being such as:  perfect-creator, immutable-creator, immutable-omniscient, and transcendence-omnipresence.
• Drange, Theodore,  2006.  “Is “God Exists” Cognitive?”  Philo 8:2.
  • Drange argues that non-cognitivism is not the best way to understand theistic claims.
• Everitt, Nicholas, 2004.  The Non-Existence of God.  London:  Routledge.
  • Everitt considers and rejects significant recent arguments for the existence of God.  Offers insightful analyses of ontological, cosmological, teleological, miracle, and pragmatic arguments.  The argument from scale and deductive atheological arguments are of particular interest
• Findlay, J.N.,  1948.  “Can God’s Existence be Disproved?”  Mind 54, pp.  176-83.
  • Influential early argument.  If there is a God, then he will be a necessary being and the ontological argument will succeed.  But the ontological argument and our efforts to make it work have not been successful.  So there is no God.
• Flew, A. and MacIntyre, A. eds., 1955, New Essays in Philosophical Theology, London: S.C.M. Press.
  • Influential early collection of British philosophers where the influence of the Vienna Circle is evident in the “logical analysis” of religion.  The meaning, function, analysis, and falsification of theological claims and discourse are considered.
• Flew, Antony. 1955. “Divine Omnipotence and Human Freedom.” in New Essays in Philosophical Theology, Anthony Flew and Alasdair MacIntyre (eds.).   New York: Macmilla
  • An early work in deductive atheology that considers the compatibility of God’s power and human freedom.
• Flew, Antony, 1984.  “The Presumption of Atheism.”  in God, Freedom, and Immortality.  Buffalo, N.Y.: Prometheus Books, pp. 13-30.
  • A collection of Flew’s essays, some of which are antiquated.  The most important are “The Presumption of Atheism,” and “The Principle of Agnosticism.”
• Flint and Freddoso, 1983. “Maximal Power.”  in The Existence and Nature of God, Alfred J. Freddoso, ed.  Notre Dame, Ind.:  University of Notre Dame Press.
  • Gives an account of omnipotence in terms of possible worlds logic and with the notion of two world sharing histories.  It attempts to avoid a number of paradoxes.
• Gale, Richard, 1991.  On the Nature and Existence of God. Cambridge:  Cambridge University Press.
  • Gale gives a careful, advanced analysis of several important deductive atheological arguments as well as the ontological and cosmological arguments, and concludes that none for theism are successful.  But he does not address inductive arguments and therefore says that he cannot answer the general question of God’s existence.
• Grim, Patrick, 1985.  “Against Omniscience:  The Case from Essential Indexicals,”  Nous, 19. pp.  151-180.
  • God cannot be omniscient because it is not possible for him to have indexical knowledge such as what I know when I know that I am making a mess.
• Grim, Patrick, 1988.  “Logic and Limits of Knowledge and Truth,” Nous 22.  pp.  341-67.
  • Uses Cantor and Gödel to argue that omniscience is impossible within any logic we have.
• Grim, Patrick, 2007.  “Impossibility Arguments.”  in The Cambridge Companion to Atheism, Michael Martin (ed).  N.Y.:  Cambridge University Press.
  • Grim outlines several recent attempts to salvage a workable definition of omnipotence from Flint and Freddoso, Wierenga, and Hoffman and Rosenkrantz.  He argues that they do not succeed leaving God’s power either impossible or too meager to be worthy of God.  Indexical problems with omniscience and a Cantorian problem render it impossible too.
• Gutting, Gary, 1982.  Religious Belief and Religious Skepticism. Notre Dame, Ind.:  University of Notre Dame Press.
  • Gutting criticizes Wittgensteinians such as Malcolm, Winch, Phillips, and Burrell before turning to Plantinga’s early notion of belief in God as basic to noetic structures.  Useful for addressing important 20^th century linguistic and epistemological turns in theism discussions.
• Harris, Sam, 2005.  The End of Faith. N.Y.:  Norton.
  • Another influential New Atheist work, although it does not contend with the best philosophical arguments for God.  Harris argues that faith is not an acceptable justification for religious belief, particularly given the dangerousness of religious agendas worldwide.  A popular, non-scholarly book that has had a broad impact on the discussion.
• Hoffman, Joshua and Rosenkrantz, 1988.  “Omnipotence Redux,”  Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 43.  pp.  283-301.
  • Defends Hoffman and Rosenkrantz’s account of omnipotence against criticisms offered by Flint, Freddoso, and Wierenga.
• Hoffman, Joshua and Rosenkrantz, 2006.  “Omnipotence,” Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
  • A good overview of the various attempts to construct a philosophically viable account of omnipotence.
• Howard-Snyder, Daniel and Moser, Paul, eds. 2001. Divine Hiddenness:  New Essays. Cambridge University Press.
  • A central collection of essays concerning the question of God’s hiddenness.  If there is a God, then why is his existence not more obvious?
• Howard-Snyder, Daniel, 1996.  “The Argument from Divine Hiddenness.”  Canadian Journal of Philosophy 26. 433-53.
  • Howard-Snyder argues that there is a prima facie good reason for God to refrain from entering into a personal relationship with inculpable nonbelievers, so there are good reasons for God to permit inculpable nonbelief.  Therefore, inculpable nonbelief does not imply atheism.
• Hume, David, 1935.  Dialogues Concerning Natural Religion, ed. Norman Kemp Smith, Oxford:  Clarendon Press.
  • Hume offers his famous dialogues between Philo, Demea, and Cleanthes in which he explores the empirical evidence for the existence of God.  No work in the philosophy of religion except perhaps Anselm or Aquinas has received more attention or had more influence.
• Kitcher, Philip, 1982.  Abusing Science Cambridge, Mass.:  MIT Press.
  • A useful, but somewhat dated and non-scholarly, presentation of the theory of evolution and critique of creationist arguments against it.
• Kretzmann, Norman, 1966.  “Omniscience and Immutability,” Journal of Philosophy 63.  pp.  409-21.
  • A perfect being is not subject to change.  A perfect being knows everything.  A being that knows everything always knows what time it is.  A being that always knows what time it is subject to change.  Therefore, a perfect being is subject to change.  Therefore, a perfect being is not a perfect being.  Therefore, there is no perfect being.
• Mackie, J. L. 1982.  The Miracle of Theism.  New York:  Oxford University Press.
  • An influential and comprehensive work.  He rejects many classic and contemporary ontological, cosmological, moral, teleological, evil, and pragmatic arguments.
• Madden, Edward and Peter Hare, eds., 1968. Evil and the Concept of God. Springfield, IL: Charles C. Thomas.
  • Madden and Hare argue against a full range of theodicies suggesting that the problem of evil cannot be adequately answered by philosophical theology.
• Manson, Neil A., ed., 2003, God and Design, London: Routledge.
  • The best recent academic collection of discussions of the design argument.
• Martin, Michael, 1990.   Atheism:  A Philosophical Justification. Philadelphia:  Temple University Press, 1990.
  • A careful and comprehensive work that surveys and rejects a broad range of arguments for God’s existence.  One of the very best attempts to give a comprehensive argument for atheism.
• Martin, Michael and Ricki Monnier, eds.  2003.  The Impossibility of God. Amherst, N.Y.:  Prometheus Press.
  • An important collection of deductive atheological arguments—the only one of its kind.  A significant body of articles arguing for the conclusion that God not only does not exist, but is impossible.
• Martin, Michael and Ricki Monnier, eds.  2006.  The Improbability of God. Amherst, N.Y.:  Prometheus Press.
  • The companion to The Impossibility of God. An important collection of inductive atheological arguments distinct from the problem of evil.  God’s existence is unreasonable.
• Matson, Wallace I., 1965.  The Existence of God. Ithaca, N.Y.:  Cornell University Press.
  • Matson critically scrutinizes the important arguments (of the day) for the existence of God.  He concludes that none of them is conclusive and that the problem of evil tips the balance against.
• Mavrodes, George, 1977.  “Defining Omnipotence,”  Philosophical Studies, 32.  pp. 191-202.
  • Mavrodes defends limiting omnipotence to exclude logically impossible acts.  It is no limitation upon a being’s power to assert that it cannot perform an incoherent act.
• McCormick, Matthew, 2000.  “Why God Cannot Think:  Kant, Omnipresence, and Consciousness,”  Philo 3:  1.  pp.  5-19.
  • McCormick argues, on Kantian grounds, that being in all places and all times precludes being conscious because omnipresence would make it impossible for God to make an essential conceptual distinction between the self and not-self.
• McCormick, Matthew,  2003.  “The Paradox of Divine Agency,” in The Impossibility of God, Martin, Michael and Ricki Monnier, eds.  Amherst, N.Y.:  Prometheus Press.
  • God is traditionally conceived of as an agent, capable of setting goals, willing and performing actions.  God can never act, however, because no state of affairs that deviates from the dictates of his power, knowledge, and perfection can arise.  Therefore, God is impossible.
• Morris, Thomas, ed. 1987.  The Concept of God, Oxford:  Oxford University Press.
  • A valuable set of discussions about the logical viability of different properties of God and their compatibility.
• Nielsen, Kai, 1985. Philosophy and Atheism. New York: Prometheus.
  • A useful collection of essays from Nielsen that addresses various, particularly epistemological, aspects of atheism.
• Nielsen, Kai, 2001. Naturalism and Religion. New York: Prometheus.
  • Defends naturalism as atheistic and adequate to answer a number of larger philosophical questions.  Considers some famous objections to naturalism including fideism and Wittgenstein.
• Oppy, Graham (1995). Ontological Arguments and Belief in God, N.Y.:  Cambridge University Press.
  • Perhaps the best and most thorough analysis of the important versions of the ontological argument.
• Oppy, Graham, 2006.  Arguing About Gods. N.Y.:  Cambridge University Press.
  • There are no successful arguments for the existence of orthodoxly conceived monotheistic gods.  This project includes some very good, up to date, analyses of rational belief and belief revision, ontological arguments, cosmological arguments, teleological arguments, Pascal’s wager, and evil.  He sees these all as fitting into a larger argument for agnosticism.
• Papineau, David, 2007.  “Naturalism,” Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
  • A good general discussion of philosophical naturalism.
• Rowe, William, 1979.  “The Problem of Evil and Some Varieties of Atheism,” American Philosophical Quarterly 16.  pp.  335-41.
  • A watershed work giving an inductive argument from evil for the non-existence of God.  This article has been anthologized and responded as much or more than any other single work in atheism.
• Rowe, William L., 1998.  “Atheism.” In E. Craig (Ed.), Routledge Encyclopedia of Philosophy. London: Routledge.
  • A good but brief survey of philosophical atheism.
• Rowe, William, 1998.  The Cosmological Argument. N.Y.:  Fordham University Press.
  • Rowe offers a thorough analysis of many important historically influential versions of the cosmological argument, especially Aquinas’, Duns Scotus’s, and Clarke’s.
• Rowe, William,  2004.  Can God Be Free? Oxford:  Oxford University Press.
  • Rowe considers a range of classic and modern arguments attempting to reconcile God’s freedom in creating the world with God’s omnipotence, omniscience, and perfect goodness. Rowe argues against their compatibility with this principle:   If an omniscient being creates a world when there is a better world that it could have created instead, then it is possible that there exist a being better than it—a being whose degree of goodness is such that it could not create that world when there is a better world it could have created instead.
• Salmon, Wesley, 1978.  “Religion and Science:  A New Look at Hume’s Dialogues,” Philosophical Studies 33 (1978):  143-176.
  • A novel Bayesian reconstruction of Hume’s treatment of design arguments.  In general, since it is exceedingly rare for things to be brought into being by intelligence, and it is common for orderly things to come into existence by non-intelligence, it is more probable that the orderly universe is not the product of intelligent design.
• Schellenberg, J.L., 1993.  Divine Hiddenness and Human Reason.  Ithaca, N.Y.:  Cornell University Press.
  • Schellenberg argues that the absence of strong evidence for theism implies that atheism is true.
• Schellenberg, J.L., 2006.  “Divine Hiddenness justifies atheism,”  Contemporary Debates in the Philosophy of Religion, ed. Peterson and VanArragon.  Oxford: Blackwell Publishing.  pp. 30-41.
  • Many people search in earnest for compelling evidence for God’s existence, but remain unconvinced and epistemically inculpable.  This state of divine hiddenness itself implies that there is no God, independent of any positive arguments for atheism.
• Smart, J.C.C.  (2004) “Atheism and Agnosticism”  Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
  • An outdated and idiosyncratic survey of the topic.  Heavily influenced by positivism from the early 20^th century.
• Smart, J.J.C. and Haldane, John, 2003.  Atheism and Theism. Oxford: Blackwell.
  • An influential exchange between Smart (atheist) and Haldane (theist)
• Smith, Quentin, 1993.  “Atheism, Theism, and Big Bang Cosmology,” in Theism, Atheism, and Big Bang Cosmology. eds. William Lane Craig and Quentin Smith.  Oxford:  Clarendon Press, pp. 195-217.
  • Smith gives a novel argument and considers several objections:  God did not create the big bang.  If he had, he would have ensured that it would unfold into a state containing living creatures.  But the big bang is inherently lawless and unpredictable and is not ensured to unfold this way.
• Sobel, Jordan Howard, 2004.  Logic and Theism, Arguments for and Against Beliefs in God. Cambridge:  Cambridge University Press.
  • A broad, conventionally structured work in that it covers ontological, cosmological, and teleological arguments, as well as the properties of God, evil, and Pascal.  Notable for its attempts to bring some sophisticated, technical logic tools to the reconstructions and analyses.
• Stenger, Victor.  2007.  God:  The Failed Hypothesis:  How Science Shows that God Does Not Exist. Prometheus Books.
  • An accessible work that considers scientific evidence that might be construed as against the existence of God:  evolution, supernaturalism, cosmology, prayer, miracles, prophecy, morality, and suffering.   Not a scholarly philosophical work, but interesting survey of relevant empirical evidence.
• Weisberger, A.M. 1999.  Suffering Belief:  Evil and the Anglo-American Defense of Theism. New York:  Peter Lang Publishing.
  • Weisberger argues that the problem of evil presents a disproof for the existence of the God of classical monotheism.
• Wierenga, Edward, 1989.  The Nature of God:  An Inquiry Into Divine Attributes. Ithaca, N.Y.:  Cornell University Press.
  • Wierenga offers an important, thorough, and recent attempt to work out the details of the various properties of God and their compatibilities.  He responds to a number of recent counterexamples to different definitions of omnipotence, omniscience, freedom, timelessness, eternality, and so on.  Employs many innovations from developments in modern logic.

Author Information

Matt McCormick
Email: mccormick@csus.edu
California State University, Sacramento
U. S. A.

Incarnation

In the Bible‘s fourth gospel, John tells us “the Word [God the Son] became flesh [incarnate] and dwelt among us” (John 1: 14). The central claim of Christianity is that Jesus of Nazareth was none other than God the Son, who while remaining fully divine, took on a human nature for the sake of our salvation. Philosophical puzzles and problems arise as soon as we begin to unpack these notions. The humans we know best, ourselves, make moral mistakes, have trouble bench pressing three hundred pounds, and lose their car keys. We are morally flawed beings lacking in both power and knowledge. God, on the other hand, is typically understood to be morally perfect, all-knowing and all-powerful. If being truly human includes moral failure and limitations in knowledge and power, and being truly divine requires moral perfection, along with perfect knowledge and power, then the incarnation runs afoul of the law of non-contradiction. This law, which Aristotle calls the most certain principle, states that nothing can both be and not be at the same time and in the same respect (Metaphysics, Bk. IV, Part 3). And so, neither Jesus of Nazareth, nor anyone or anything else, can simultaneously have a property (for example, be all-powerful) and lack it (for example, be limited in power).

The apparent conflict between the law of non-contradiction and the metaphysical claim that one person, Jesus of Nazareth, is both human and divine is not news to philosophers of religion. Some of the best philosophical minds in the past and present have wrestled with this problem. Four approaches stand out. Beginning with the most radical approach, some simply reject the law of non-contradiction. If the incarnation runs afoul of the law non-contradiction, so much the worse for that law. Less radically, one might argue that identity is not an all-or-nothing affair, and hold that there is a significant sense in which Jesus of Nazareth and God the Son could be identical without having all of the same properties. In technical terms, making this move requires giving up a principle called the indiscernibility of identicals in favor of a relative account of identity. If, by affirming relative identity, one could hold that Jesus of Nazareth is identical to God the Son, even though they do not have all the same properties, one could affirm both the incarnation and the law of non-contradiction.

Many philosophers have argued that one need not appeal to relative identity to reconcile the incarnation with the law of non-contradiction. Here there are two approaches to consider. First, some argue that the incarnation appears to flout this law because we have misunderstood the kinds of properties required for being truly human and/or truly divine. Second, some hold that the incarnation seems to run afoul of the law of non-contradiction because we have failed to see the way in which God the Son Incarnate possesses properties and their complements. Only if the incarnation required that God the Son Incarnate both be and not be at the same time and in the same respect, would it be incompatible with the law of non-contradiction.  The doctrine does not require this, and therefore is completely compatible with the law of non-contradiction. This article considers these various responses to the philosophical problem of incarnation.

Table of Contents

1. The Historical Framework
2. The Incompatibility Problem
3. Responses to the Incompatibility Problem
   1. Rejecting the Law of Non-contradiction
   2. Rejecting the All-or-Nothing Account of Identity in Favor of Relative Identity
   3. Reconsidering the Properties Required for Being Truly Human and/or Truly Divine
      1. Reconsidering the Properties Required for Being Truly Human
         1. Thomas V. Morris’s Distinctions Between Essential and Common Properties, and Full and Mere Humanity
         2. Richard Swinburne’s Rejection of a Human Mind/Soul in Favor of a Human Range of Consciousness
      2. Reconsidering the Properties Required for Being Truly Divine: the Kenotic Approach
      3. Reconsidering the Properties Required for Being Truly Divine and Truly Human: Marilyn Adams’ Qualified-Property Approach
   4. Showing that God the Son Incarnate Does Not Possess Any Property and its Complement “in the same respect”: Eleonore Stump’s Borrowed-Property View
4. Conclusion
5. References and Further Reading

1. The Historical Framework

The word “Incarnation” derives from the Latin (in + carnis), which means “in the flesh.” Philosophers writing on the incarnation invariably refer to the classical or orthodox view of the incarnation, and here they have in mind the Chalcedonian Creed (451 [MP1]). Stephen T. Davis is typical: “This is the dogma (the Chalcedonian Creed) I have been calling the classical doctrine of the incarnation. It constituted something of a consensus in Christendom from the time of Chalcedon until recently” (Davis, 2006, 99). The creed defines what it means for God the Son to be incarnate, but does so in a way that allows for considerable metaphysical latitude. In the words of C. Stephen Evans, “This formulation at Chalcedon does not attempt a theoretical understanding of what it means for Jesus of Nazareth to be God Incarnate; it simply lays down some boundaries for what is to count as an orthodox Christian understanding of Jesus’ status” (Evans, 2006a,1 ).

In order to stay within the confines of orthodoxy, metaphysical accounts of the incarnation must preserve Jesus Christ’s divinity, humanity, and identity with God the Son. In other words, they must be compatible with three theses:

1) Jesus Christ is truly divine; in the language of Chalcedon: “. . . the same perfect in Godhead . . . truly God . . . consubstantial with the Father in Godhead” (Olson, 1999, 231).

2) Jesus Christ is truly human; in the words of the creed: “. . . the same in perfect manhood . . . truly man, the same of a rational soul and body. . .consubstantial with us in manhood; like us in all things except sin. . . ” (Olson, 1999, 231).

3) Jesus Christ is a single individual identical to God the Son; in the words of Chalcedon: “. . . made known in two natures without confusion, without change, without division, without separation; the difference of the natures being by no means removed because of the union but rather the property of each nature being preserved, and coalescing in one person (prosopon) and one hypostasis, not parted or divided into two persons, but one and the same Son, only-begotten, the divine Word, the Lord Jesus Christ . . . ” (Olson, 1999, 231-232).

We would do well to keep these three theses in mind as we consider “Responses to the Incompatibility Problem.” Insofar as a response emphasizes the distinction between the human and divine, the third thesis will be most relevant for its evaluation. For responses that emphasize a reconsideration of the properties required for being truly human, the second thesis will be most pertinent for an assessment of it. And, as an approach focuses on a reconsideration of the constitutive properties of divinity, the first thesis is the most important one for its evaluation.

Finally, it is important to note some of the views these theses rule out. Arius (250-336), bishop of Alexandria, taught that the Son is “God’s perfect creature” (Olson, 146) and therefore a lesser being than God the Father. Arian views deny the full divinity of God the Son and therefore are incompatible with the first thesis. Apollinarius, a 4th-century bishop of Laodicea, denied that God the Son Incarnate possessed a human mind as well as a human body. Apollinarian views deny the full humanity of God the Son Incarnate and therefore are incompatible with the second thesis. Nestorianism, taking its name from Nestorius, a 5th-century bishop of Constantinople, holds that in God the Son Incarnate there are two persons, one human and one divine, and is therefore incompatible with the third thesis.

2. The Incompatibility Problem

According to the classical account of the incarnation, Jesus Christ is truly human, truly divine, and a single individual who is identical to God the Son. Suppose that, as a matter of fact, Jesus of Nazareth worked as a carpenter, went fishing on the Sea of Galilee, and was unpopular with some civil and religious leaders. Things could have gone differently. Conceivably, Jesus might have been a potter who never set foot on the beaches of Galilee, and was unknown to the movers and shakers of his time. Either way he would have been truly human.

Characteristics or properties relating to employment, popularity, trips to the sea, and the like are compatible with being human but not essential for having that status. Just what properties are essential for being truly human is, as we shall see, a topic of considerable debate.

John Hick counts limited power and knowledge among the plausible candidates and argues that this spells trouble for the adherent of the Chalcedonian account of the incarnation, for the complements of these properties, unlimited knowledge and power, are essential for being truly divine.

. . . there is an obvious puzzle as to how the same being can jointly
embody those attributes of God and of humanity that are apparently
incompatible. God is eternal, whilst humans have a beginning in time;
God is infinite, humans finite; God is the creator of the universe,
including humanity, whilst humans are part of God’s creation; God is
omnipotent, omniscient, omnipresent, whilst humans are limited in power
and knowledge and have a bounded location; and so on. Let us call this
the incompatible-attributes problem (Hick, 1993,102).

The worry, then, is that the classic account of the incarnation is flawed in the most fundamental sense; it runs counter to what Aristotle called the most certain principle: nothing can both be and not be at the same time and in the same respect (Metaphysics, Bk. IV, Part 3). If being truly human and being truly divine are indeed incompatible, then Jesus could no more have fulfilled the conditions of the Chalcedonian account of the incarnation than he could have been a spherical cube.

3. Responses to the Incompatibility Problem

a. Rejecting the Law of Non-contradiction

Toward the end of his journal, A Grief Observed, C.S. Lewis asks “Can a mortal ask questions which God finds unanswerable?” and readily replies in the affirmative.

Quite easily, I should think. All nonsense questions are unanswerable.
How many hours are there in a mile? Is yellow square or round? Probably
half of the questions we ask─half our great theological and metaphysical
problems─are like that (Lewis, 1961, 81).

Though there is no reason to think that Lewis had questions about the incarnation in mind, one could respond to the objection that the Chalcedonian account of the incarnation runs counter to the law of non-contradiction, by arguing that this law no more applies to the incarnation than geometric properties do to colors. Asking if God the Son’s human nature is compatible with his divine nature, would be like asking if purple is perpendicular. It is what philosophers call ‘a category mistake,’ the error of applying concepts and distinctions to subjects where they have no purchase. In this regard, Thomas V. Morris cites H. M. Relton as asserting that “the person of Christ is the bankruptcy of human logic;” Soren Kierkegaard (1813-1855) as holding that the incarnation is “a breach with all thinking,” and notes Gareth Moore’s reference to those for whom “The doctrine of the incarnation expressed a divine mystery which we mere mortals could not expect to understand, and it was bordering on the blasphemous for any feeble, logic-chopping human intellect to attack it” (Morris, 1986, 24-25).

To evaluate rejecting the law of non-contradiction, as a response to the charge that some essential human and divine properties are incompatible, let’s assume, for the sake of the argument, that the law does not apply to the incarnation. Since it tells us that nothing can both be and not be at the same time and in the same respect, making our assumption amounts to holding that God the Son could possess any property (for example, having unlimited power) and its complement (for example, having limited power).

If this were so, there could not be any problem with God the Son being truly human and truly divine, no matter how we understand ‘humanity’ and ‘divinity.’ But the same problem-free possibility would also go for God the Son being truly divine and incarnate as a doorknob, the number seven or a piece of toast. Furthermore, apart from the law of non-contradiction, God the Son Incarnate could both have any property (for example, being human) and its complement (for example, not being human), at the same time and in the same respect.  However, if having a property does not rule out its absence, then all property distinctions (for example, being incarnate and not being incarnate) break down. As such, doing away with the law of non-contradiction, in order to defend the doctrine of the incarnation, leads to the loss all meaningful property distinctions, and the significance of theological assertions. What we need is a way to work within the metaphysical constraints of Chalcedon, not a way to shake them off altogether.

b. Rejecting the All-or-Nothing Account of Identity in Favor of Relative Identity

Our first attempt to address the incompatibility problem plaguing the Chalcedonian account of the incarnation ─ rejecting the law of  non-contradiction ─ led to the breakdown of meaningful property distinctions. A less radical approach for responding to the incompatibility problem requires a fresh look at the concept of identity. So far, in our reasoning, we have assumed that Jesus of Nazareth could be identical to God the Son only if Jesus possessed every property had by God the Son, and vice versa. In doing so, we have supposed that identity is an all-or-nothing affair. This view of identity is expressed in a principle Leibniz called the indiscernibility of identicals:

For any property P and any persons X and Y, if X is identical with Y then X has P if and only if Y has P (cf. Plantinga, 1976, 15).

Given both the law of non-contradiction and the indiscernibility of identicals, it is difficult indeed to see how Jesus of Nazereth could be identical to God the Son. Suppose Jesus is limited in power and God the Son is essentially all-powerful. The law of non-contradiction rules out the possibility of Jesus having both unlimited and limited power, and also the possibility of God the Son having both limited and unlimited power. But, the indiscernibility of identicals requires Jesus to have unlimited power in order to be identical to God the Son, and God the Son to have limited power in order to be identical to Jesus. It seems, then, that an acceptance of both the law of non-contradiction and the indiscernibility of identicals rules out the Chalcedonian view that a single individual can be both truly divine and truly human. So, if we want to affirm Chalcedon and retain the law of non-contradiction, it makes sense to consider rejecting the all-or-nothing account of identity expressed by the indiscernibility of identicals.

Some suggest that instead of thinking of identity as sameness in all respects, as in the indiscernibility of identicals, we should think of it as sameness in just some respects. On this account of identity, relative identity, two things, X and Y, can be identical in some respects but not others. So, for example, Senator Barack Obama and President Barack Obama are the same person but not the same official. As an official, Senator Barack Obama is a member of the legislative branch of government, while President Barack Obama, as an official, is a member of the executive branch of government.

The qualifiers in the Obama example, “person” and “official,” are count nouns, nouns we can modify numerically. It makes sense to speak of two persons or officials, but not of two courages or honesties. It follows, then, that while “person” and “official” are count nouns, “courage” and “honesty” are not.

For our present purposes, let’s suppose that Jesus of Nazareth is the same person as God the Son, but the two differ relative to X, where X does duty for some count noun. Let’s suppose that, relative to this count noun, Jesus is limited in knowledge and power and the like, and therefore not all-powerful and all-knowing, while God the Son is all-powerful and all-knowing and the like, and so not limited in power and knowledge.

Such an interpretation seems to be necessary if an appeal to relative identity is to show that Jesus of Nazareth and God the Son can be identical, notwithstanding property differences. However, it requires attributing essential human properties, like limited power, to Jesus but not God the Son, and essential divine properties, like unlimited knowledge, to God the Son but not Jesus of Nazareth. As a result, it is hard to see how an appeal to relative identity can be compatible with Chalcedon’s requirement that the divine and human natures be “. . . without division, without separation . . . coalescing in one person (prosopon) and one hypostasis. . . “(Olson, 1999, 231), in keeping with the third Chalcedonian thesis.

c. Reconsidering the Properties Required for Being Truly Human and/or Truly Divine

It is easy to assume, along with John Hick, that to be truly human God the Son had to be limited in knowledge and power, and, in general, possess the complements of essential divine properties. However, if Hick’s assumptions were unwarranted, then the doctrine of the incarnation would be perfectly compatible with the law of non-contradiction. We should then at least entertain the possibility that incompatibility problems show that our assumptions about the essential properties of humanity and/or divinity are incorrect.

i. Reconsidering the Properties Required for Being Truly Human

1) Thomas V. Morris’s Distinctions Between Essential and Common Properties, and Full and Mere Humanity

Thomas V. Morris challenges our assumptions regarding the properties necessary for being truly human. He does so, by drawing our attention to two crucial─but commonly overlooked─distinctions. First, Morris asks us to consider the distinction between being fully but not merely X, and being fully and merely X. For example, a cube, like a two-dimensional square, is fully a rectangle, as each one of the cube’s faces is a parallelogram with four right angles. However, a cube is not merely a rectangle, for it possesses a higher-level property; it is three-dimensional. A diamond-backed rattlesnake, like a diamond, is fully physical; it has a spatiotemporal location. But, a rattlesnake is not merely physical for it possesses higher-level properties diamonds lack, for example, cellular composition and voluntary motion. Similarly, God the Son Incarnate is fully but not merely human. He has all of the properties individually necessary and jointly sufficient for being human, but also higher-level divine properties.

Second, Morris draws our attention to the distinction between properties commonly possessed by humans and properties essential to humanity. By definition, if a property is essential for being human, all humans must have it. So, essential human properties are necessarily common human properties. However, the reverse does not hold. A property can be common without being essential. Breaking promises is a common human property but is not thereby an essential human property. God the Son’s genuine humanity would not have been jeopardized by his faithfully fulfilling all of his promises.

Further, if we neglect these distinctions, we may incorrectly assume that properties commonly possessed by those who are merely human are necessary for being fully human. Morris thinks that this is exactly what we have done. We have assumed that the properties commonly possessed by mere humans, for example, limited knowledge and power, are necessary for being fully human. Once we see that this is not so, the incarnation is no longer an affront to the law of non-contradiction.

Morris’s approach is bold and intriguing. Whether or not it is ultimately satisfactory, depends upon the strength of responses to the concerns it raises. First, if we allow, for the sake of the argument, that properties like limited knowledge and power are not essential for being fully human, we might  well ask, “What are essential?” In response, Morris takes a wait-and-see approach, “What essentially constitutes a human body and a human mind we wait upon a perfected science or a more complete revelation to say. We have neither a very full-blown nor a very fine-grained understanding of either at this point” (Morris, 1991, 166).

Second, we might ask “if properties like limited power and knowledge are not essential for being fully human, why are they so common?” Morris suggests that what makes these properties so common is either that they are included in our individual human natures, or they are the result of being merely human, that is, not possessing some additional nature (Morris, 1991, 165). Thus, the reason why Thomas V. Morris ─ and the rest of us ─ is limited in power and knowledge is either that his human nature is not possessed along with some higher nature, or because his individual nature ─ the properties essential for being the particular human that is Thomas V. Morris ─ includes limitations in power and knowledge.

There is a third concern. Morris rightly recognizes that an internally consistent account of the incarnation is not the only desideratum; he also wants an account that squares with the New Testament portrait of Jesus of  Nazareth. Morris must explain how it is that God the Son Incarnate could be, as described in the gospels, limited in power and knowledge (for example, Mark 13:32; John 4:6), even though he remained omnipotent and omniscient. Morris’s answer is that God the Son Incarnate had both a divine and human mind, and sometimes chose to rely only upon the resources of his human mind.

. . .  in the case of God Incarnate we must recognize something like two distinct minds or systems of mentality. There is first what we can call the eternal mind of God the Son, with its distinctively divine consciousness . . . encompassing the full scope of omniscience, empowered by the resources of  omnipotence, and present in power and knowledge throughout the entirety of the creation. And, in addition to this divine mind, there is a distinctly earthly mind with its consciousness that came into existence and developed with the conception, human birth and growth of Christ’s earthly form of   existence. . . . By living out his earthly life from on the resources of the human body and mind, he took on the form of our existence and shared the plight of our   condition (Morris, 1991, 169).

Talk of two minds inevitably raises the specter of two persons and Nestorianism. On a Cartesian view of persons, a human mind is a human person. From this perspective, if the incarnation required both a divine mind and human mind, then in God the Son Incarnate there were two persons, one human and one divine. Morris is aware of the concern and grants that in the case of mere humans, a human mind is a human person, “What we can refer to as my mental system was intended by God to define a person” (Morris, 1991, 174). However, for God incarnate, one who is fully human, but not merely human, having a human mind is not sufficient for being a human person. That individual’s personhood depends upon his ultimate metaphysical status, in this case divinity (Morris, 1991, 174).

2) Richard Swinburne’s Rejection of a Human Mind/Soul in Favor of a Human Range of Consciousness

At the core of Richard Swinburne’s account of the incarnation is the claim that God the Son Incarnate has both a human range of consciousness and a divine range of consciousness. In this way his view is akin to Thomas V. Morris’s. However, there is a crucial difference between their accounts. Morris holds that God the Son Incarnate has two minds, a divine mind and a human mind, each with its own range of consciousness.

Swinburne argues that God the Son Incarnate has a single mind with two ranges of consciousness. Instead of Morris’s two-minds view of the incarnation, Swinburne offers a divided-mind account of the incarnation.

To understand what Swinburne’s divided-mind view amounts to and why he prefers it to Morris’s two-minds view, we need to consider his understanding of humanity. In general, a mental substance, that is, a soul/mind, is human if it has a human body and is capable of “acting, acquiring beliefs, sensations and desires through it” (Swinburne, 1994, 196). Note that on this view, a mental substance is human only if it has a human body.

Richard Swinburne and the rest of us are human. But, by Swinburne’s reckoning, we are not essentially so. This follows from the fact that having a human body is a necessary condition for being human, and it is conceivable that we exist either without a body or with a very different sort of body. But, while no soul is essentially human, one soul became human by choice.

In taking on a human body and acquiring a human range of consciousness, God the Son did not lose omnipotence or omniscience. Indeed, he could not do so, for he is essentially divine, and omnipotence and omniscience belong to the divine nature. Instead, by becoming human, God the Son acquired additional ways of accessing the world; he took on “a way of operating which is limited and feels limited” (Swinburne, 1989, 66). So, we can explain references in the gospels to God the Son’s ignorance and powerlessness, as the results of the Son only relying on his human range of consciousness and abilities.

Because of his divided-mind account of the incarnation, Richard Swinburne steers clear of Nestorianism, for without two minds there cannot be two persons. That said, some may worry that without two minds, there cannot be two natures. If this is so, then Swinburne’s divided-mind view of the incarnation avoids Nestorianism only by taking an Apollinarian position in which God the Son incarnate has a human body but lacks a human mind.

Swinburne is well aware of the apparent problem and has a ready response. His view would be Apollinarian, if, in their talk about taking on a “reasonable soul,” the Fathers of Chalcedon had wished to affirm that God the Son took on an immaterial substance, a Cartesian soul so to speak. But that could not have been their view for then they would have been committed to a position they expressly denied, namely, that in the incarnation there are two beings. Instead, we should understand “soul” in the creed’s reference to “reasonable soul,” in an Aristotelian sense. So understood, to say that God the Son took on a human soul is to claim that he acquired “a human way of thinking and acting” (Swinburne, 1989, 61, note 12). If this reading of Chalcedon is correct, then Swinburne’s account does not entail Apollinarianism.

ii. Reconsidering the Properties Required for Being Truly Divine: the Kenotic Approach

The counterpart to reconsidering what properties are essential to humanity is a reexamination of the properties essential to divinity. If we have reason to believe ─ contrary to Thomas V. Morris’s suggestion ─ that limited knowledge and power are not just common human properties but essential ones, consistency requires that we no longer count omnipotence and omniscience as essential divine properties. There is data in the New Testament that would support revising the list of essential divine properties. The New Testament records tell us that God the Son was sometimes tired (John 4:6) and that he grew in wisdom (Luke 2:52). When these descriptions are considered along side of Philippians 2:7, which tells us that God the Son “emptied himself” in order to become incarnate, it is reasonable to suppose that God the Son Incarnate relinquished properties such as omnipotence and omniscience. This approach to the incarnation is known as the kenotic view, in keeping with the Greek verb keneo, “to empty,” found in Philippians 2:7.

In order for God the Son to be able to give up properties like omnipotence and omniscience, two things need to be true. First, none of these properties could be essential properties of divinity, for God the Son is, by his very nature, divine, and no being can lose an essential property and continue to exist. Second, all of these properties, if possessed by God the Son, or another member of the Trinity, must be compatible with the essential properties of divinity, for God the Son can relinquish only what he can possess, and can possess only properties compatible with his divine nature.

It is important to distinguish God the Son’s relinquishing of properties like omniscience and omnipotence in the kenotic view, with the views of Morris and Swinburne on which God the Son chose not to avail himself of these properties for a period of time. For Morris and Swinburne, omnipotence and omniscience are essential divine properties and therefore ones that God the Son must always have. On the kenotic view these properties are accidental and therefore properties that God the Son can lose. On the kenotic view, there was a period of time during which God the Son could not possibly avail himself of omnipotence and omniscience (Evans, 2006b, 200).

If properties like omnipotence and omniscience are not essential divine properties, one might well ask: in what sense are power and knowledge essential to divinity? The kenotic response is that, it is not omnipotence but omnipotence unless freely given up, not omniscience but omniscience unless freely given up, that are essential properties of divinity. On the kenotic view, God the Son gives up the “omni properties” in order to become incarnate, while retaining the “unless properties.”

If “omni properties” are not essential for divinity, then God the Father and God the Holy Spirit could also give up omnipotence and omniscience. If all three persons of the Trinity did so simultaneously ─ and to the extent God the Son did at the beginning of the incarnation ─ there would be a time when many ordinary humans would surpass God in knowledge and power. This seems sufficient for a reductio ad absurdum of the kenotic view.

Ronald J. Feenstra sees the problematic nature of a complete Trinitarian kenosis, and so suggests a further refinement of essential divine properties, replacing omnipotence unless freely given up with omnipotence unless freely given up for the sake of reconciliation and omniscience unless freely given up with omniscience unless freely given up for the sake of reconciliation. Given this fine-tuning and an assumption that God the Son has accomplished the work of redemption, it would no longer be possible to have an absurd scenario in which many humans surpass all three members of the Trinity in knowledge and power (Feenstra, 2006, 153).

There would, however, be another problem: the kenotic approach would appear ad hoc, inviting the following question: “Apart from rescuing a Chalcedonian account of the incarnation, is there any reason to suppose that God has these fine-tuned kenotic properties?” In response, the kenotic theologian might argue, in keeping with Alvin Plantinga’s “Advice to Christian Philosophers” (Plantinga, 1984), that it is perfectly appropriate to begin with what we know about the incarnation and revise our concepts of God and humanity accordingly (Feenstra, 2006, 159).

By the same token, if there is a conflict between special revelation and the kenotic account of the incarnation, the latter must go. C. Stephen Evans, a defender of the kenotic approach, draws our attention to just such an apparent conflict concerning the glorification of God the Son Incarnate and expresses it in the form of a dilemma (Evans 2002, 263-264).

• ŸEither the glorified God the Son Incarnate reassumes the properties he set aside or not.
• ŸIf so, these properties are compatible with God the Son’s incarnation, contrary to the kenotic view.
• ŸIf not, the kenotic view has a deficient account of the glorification of God the Son Incarnate.
• ŸSo, either the kenotic approach is incorrect in supposing that God the Son’s incarnation requires setting aside certain properties or it is committed to a deficient account of God the Son’s glorification.

In response to this dilemma, a kenotic defender could distinguish between incarnation and kenosis, and argue that while kenosis entails incarnation, the reverse is not true. It may be that kenosis was the means by which God the Son became incarnate and subsequently shared our trials and temptations (Feenstra 1989, 148-150). However, kenosis and incarnation are not co-extensive for, while God the Son’s kenosis ends at his glorification, his incarnation does not. Evans suggests that “. . . Christ’s Incarnation in an ordinary body may have required a kenosis, but the kind of body he possesses in his glorified state may be compatible with the reassumption of all of the traditional theistic properties” (Evans 206b., 201-202). If this is right, then limited power and knowledge are not essential human properties after all. The relevant essential properties are more fine-grained: being limited in power while having an ordinary (unglorified) human body, being limited in knowledge while having an ordinary (ungloried) human body and so forth. So, God the Son gave up the properties like omnipotence and omniscience, not because he had to do so to be truly human─or else the glorified Son of God would not be truly human─but because our redemption required it.

iii. Reconsidering the Properties Required for Being Truly Divine and  Truly Human: Marilyn Adams’ Qualified-Property Approach

Marilyn Adams holds that, barring a miracle, every human individual is  essentially human. In the miracle of the incarnation God the Son, who is essentially divine, acquires a human nature. As a result, God the Son is not only truly divine, but also truly human. However, since God the Son is not essentially human, none of the properties included in his human nature are among his essential properties.

In virtue of possessing a divine nature, God the Son has the property of being uncreated, while in virtue of having a human nature, he possesses the property of being created. Possessing both of these properties appears to be a violation of the law of non-contradiction, which tells us that nothing can both be and not be at the same time and in the same respect. Adams, however, taking her cue from Duns Scotus (1266-1308) (Adams, 2006, 133), argues that there is no incompatibility with the law of non-contradiction. As she sees it, strictly speaking, God the Son Incarnate does not possess the property pair: being created and being uncreated, but rather the pair: uncreated as (qua) divine and created as (qua) human. Further, since God the Son Incarnate is essentially divine and contingently human, he possesses the property of being uncreated, without qualification (simpliciter) and the property of being created, with qualification. Either way we choose to describe the difference between God the Son’s essential possession of his divine properties and contingent possession of his human properties, God the Son does not possess them in the same sense. Therefore there is no violation of the law of non-contradiction.

Adams goes on to note that Richard Cross (Cross, 2002, 204-205) “remains dubious” about this approach (Adams, 2006, 133). Chalcedon requires that God the Son Incarnate be “consubstantial with us in manhood; like us in all things except sin” (Olson, 1999, 231). However, what we possess is the property of being created, simpliciter, a property that God the Son Incarnate cannot possess as he has the property of being uncreated, simpliciter. It seems then that the distinction between properties God the Son Incarnate possesses with and without qualification, keeps the incarnation in line with the law of non-contradiction only by denying a core Chalcedonian claim – God the Son Incarnate is like us, save for sin. In response, Adams argues that the difficulty is only apparent, for the content of God the Son Incarnate’s human nature is the same as our nature; what differs is the way the content is attributed to him.

Commentators needlessly worry that if the Divine Word does not possess human nature in the way we do . . . in such a way that we could not exist without being human ─ then the Divine Word isn’t fully or perfectly human ─ i.e., doesn’t really possess all of what goes into being a human being. What the doctrine requires is that the Divine Word ─while essentially Divine ─ contingently come to possess human nature in such a way as to be characterized by such features. So far as I know, no one . . . has envisioned the Divine Word possessing human nature essentially in such a way that the Divine Word couldn’t exist without being human (Adams, 2006, 134).

d. Showing that God the Son Incarnate Does Not Possess Any Property and its Complement “in the same respect”: Eleonore Stump’s Borrowed-Property View

Given the law of non-contradiction, God the Son Incarnate cannot both have and lack a property at the same time and in the same respect. To see how God the Son might have a property in one respect, but lack it in another, it is helpful to consider some everyday examples of this sort of thing. An apple, with respect to its skin, has the property of being red, but, with respect to its whitish inside, lacks that property. So, the apple has and lacks the property of being red, but there is no incoherence here because the apple has that property in one respect and lacks it in another (Leftow, 1992, 288). Similarly, a knife, with respect to its cutting edge, has the property of being sharp, but with respect to its handle, lacks that property. So, the knife has and lacks the property of being sharp, but there is no incoherence here for the knife has this property in one respect, but lacks it in another.

On the classical view of the incarnation, God the Son Incarnate is truly human and truly divine. Some, John Hick for example, hold that there cannot be a truly human and truly divine individual because, for example, such a being would have to possess omnipotence, to be fully divine, and lack it, to be fully human. This would indeed be problematic if God the Son Incarnate had to have and lack omnipotence at the same time and in the same respect. However, given that God the Son Incarnate has two natures, he can have some properties with respect to one nature and lack them with respect to the other nature. God Incarnate, with respect to his divine nature, is omnipotent, but with respect to his human nature, is not. God Incarnate, with respect to his human nature, is ignorant of some things, but, with respect to his divine nature, is not.

There is a significant objection to this way of reconciling the classical account of the incarnation with the law of non-contradiction; it only avoids running afoul of the law of non-contradiction by, contrary to Chalcedon, “dividing the natures” of God Incarnate. If one must treat God Incarnate’s human and divine natures as watertight compartments in order to avoid contradiction, then one must also give up the Chalcedonian claim that the two natures combine in one person. Or, to put a positive spin on it, if one is going to appeal to God the Son’s natures to show that he can possess a property with respect to one nature but not another ─ and stay within the bounds of Chalcedon ─ one will need to show how a property can be had relative to a nature, without being had only by that nature. By way of example, one will need to show that God the Son himself, not just his divine nature, can have the property of omnipotence, even though he is omnipotent only because that property belongs to his divine nature. Also, one would need to show that God the Son himself, can have the property of lacking strength, even though he has that property only because it is a part of his human nature. Though this description of the requisite demonstration has the appearance of an impossibility, Eleonore Stump  argues that with the notion of a “borrowed property” ─ a concept she finds implicit in Thomas Aquinas’s (1225-1274) work on the incarnation (Stump, 2002, 205-206) ─ it is possible to steer clear of contradiction and stay within the confines of Chalcedon.

For an explicit account of borrowed property, Eleonore Stump draws on the work of Lynne Rudder Baker:

Borrowing walks a fine line. On the one hand, if x borrows H from y, then x really has H-piggyback, so to speak . . . If I cut my hand, then I really bleed . . . I borrow the property of bleeding from my body, but I really bleed. But the fact that I am bleeding is none other than the fact that I am constituted by a body that is bleeding. So, not only does x really have H by borrowing it, but also ─ and this is the other hand ─ if x borrows H from y, there are not two independent instances of H: if x borrows H, then x’s having H is entirely a matter of having constitution elations to something that has H non-derivatively. [quoted in (Stump 2002), p. 205]

Stump provides an illustration of borrowed properties. She notes that Mark Twain’s Letters From the Earth is both comic and serious; as a biting critique of Christianity it is serious and as a satire it is comic. The work as a whole borrows the property of seriousness from its overall aim, while borrowing its comic property from Twain’s sarcasm and humor. So, Letters From the Earth is serious, with respect to its attack on Christianity, and comic, with respect to Twain’s use of humor. In a like manner, God the Son is omniscient with respect to his divine nature, and limited in knowledge with respect to his human nature. Just as the apparently incompatible properties, being comic and being serious, can be predicated of Letters From the Earth as a whole, when they are taken to be borrowed properties, so property pairs like unlimited knowledge and limited knowledge can be predicated of the person, God the Son, when they are understood as borrowed properties. The person, God the Son, borrows the property of omniscience from his divine nature and the property of limited knowledge from his human nature. As such, God the Son as (qua) divine is omniscient and as (qua) human is limited in knowledge.

4. Conclusion

The claim that God the Son Incarnate is truly human and truly divine appears to run afoul of the law of non-contradiction, which states that nothing can both be and not be at the same time and in the same respect. Four approaches to this incompatibility problem stand out: giving up the law of non-contradiction; adopting a relative account of identity; reconsidering the properties required for being truly human and/or divine; showing that God Incarnate does not possess any property and its complement in the same respect. Versions of the third and fourth approaches include Thomas V. Morris’s two-minds view, Richard Swinburne’s divided-mind account, Ronald J. Feenstra’s kenotic view, Marilyn Adams’ qualified-property perspective, and Eleonore Stump’s borrowed-property account. Significantly, all of these philosophers argue that their positions are compatible with the Chalcedonian Creed.

5. References and Further Reading

• Adams, Marilyn McCord. 2006. Christ and Horrors. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Cross, Richard. 2002. The Metaphysics of God Incarnate. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Davis, Stephen T. 2006. Christian Philosophical Theology. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Evans, C. Stephen. 2002. “The Self-Emptying of Love: Some Thoughts on Kenotic Christology” in Davis, Stephen T.; Kendall, Daniel, SJ; O’Collins, Gerald, S.J. eds. The Incarnation. Oxford: Oxford University Press. pp. 246-272.
• Evans, C. Stephen. 2006a. “Introduction” in C. Stephen Evans ed. Exploring Kenotic Christology: The Self-Emptying of God. Oxford: Oxford University Press. pp. 1-24.
• Evans, C. Stephen. 2006b. “Kenotic Christology and the Nature of God” in C. Stephen Evans ed. Exploring Kenotic Christology: The Self-Emptying of God. Oxford: Oxford University Press. pp. 190-217.
• Feenstra, Ronald J. 1989. “Reconsidering Kenotic Christology” in Feenstra, Ronald J. and Plantinga, Cornelius, Jr. eds. Trinity Incarnation and Atonement. Notre Dame, IN: University of Notre Dame Press.
• Feenstra, Ronald J. 2006 “A Kenotic Christological Method for Understanding the Divine Attributes” in C. Stephen Evans ed. Exploring Kenotic Christology: The Self-Emptying of God. Oxford: Oxford University Press. pp. 139-164.
• Hick, John. 1993. The Metaphor of God Incarnate. Louisville, KY: Westminster Press.
• Leftow, Brian. 1992. “A Timeless God Incarnate ” in eds. Davis, Stephen T.; Kendall, Daniel, SJ; O’Collins, Gerald, S.J. eds. The Incarnation. Oxford: Oxford University Press. pp. 273-299.
• Lewis, C.S. 1961. A Grief Observed. New York: Bantam Books.
• Morris, Thomas V. 1986. The Logic of God Incarnate. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press.
• Morris, Thomas V. 1991. Our Idea of God. Notre Dame, IN: University of Notre Dame Press.
• Olson, Roger E. 1999. The Story of Christian Theology. Downers Grove, IL: InterVarsity Press.
• Plantinga, Alvin. 1976. The Nature of Necessity. Oxford, Oxford University Press.
• Plantinga, Alvin. 1984. “Advice to Christian Philosophers” in Faith and Philosophy, Vol. 1, Number 3. pp. 253-271.
• Stump, Eleonore. 2002. “Aquinas’ Metaphysics of Incarnation” in eds. Davis, Stephen T.; Kendall, Daniel, SJ; O’Collins, Gerald, S.J. eds. The Incarnation. Oxford: Oxford University Press. pp. 197-220.
• Swinburne, Richard. 1989. “Could God Become Man?” in ed. Godfrey Vesey, The Philosophy in Christianity. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press. pp.53-70.
• Swinburne, Richard. 1994. The Christian God. Oxford: Clarendon Press.

Author information

David Werther
Email: dwerther@dcs.wisc.edu
University of Wisconsin, Madison
U. s. A.

Miracles

The term “miracle” is used very broadly in ordinary language. A quick review of news stories may turn up reports such as that of a “Christmas Miracle,” by which the Texas gulf coast came to be blanketed with snow by a rare storm. We speak of miracle drugs, or of miracle babies, and some household products purport to be miraculous as well. Philosophical discussion of the miraculous, however, is confined to the use to which religion—and in particular, theistic religion—puts that conception. These philosophical discussions center around two overlapping issues.

The first of these issues is a conceptual one: What is a miracle? Controversy over the conception of a miracle focuses primarily on whether a miracle must be, in some sense, contrary to natural law. Must it, in particular, be a violation of natural law? Supposing that it must be, a second question arises, namely, whether the conception of such a violation is a coherent one.

Philosophers have also been concerned about what sort of observable criteria would allow us to identify an event as a miracle, particularly insofar as that means identifying it as a violation of natural law. How, for example, can we tell the difference between a case in which an event is a genuine violation—assuming that some sense can be made of this notion—and one that conforms to some natural law that is unknown to us? And given the occurrence of a genuine violation, how are we to determine whether it is due to divine agency, or whether it is nothing more than a spontaneous lapse in the natural order?

The second main issue is epistemological: Once we settle on what a miracle is, can we ever have good reason to believe that one has taken place? This question is generally connected with the problem of whether testimony, such as that provided by scriptural sources, can ever give us adequate reason to believe that a miracle has occurred.

Table of Contents

1. The Definition of “Miracle”
2. Miracles and Worldview
3. The Credibility of Witnesses
4. Hume’s Argument
5. Problems With Hume’s Argument
   1. Does Hume’s Argument Beg the Question?
6. Conceptual Difficulties I: The Logical Impossibility of a Violation
   1. Violations as Nonrepeatable Counterinstances to Natural Law
   2. Miracles as Outside the Scope of Natural Laws
7. Conceptual Difficulties II: Identifying Miracles
8. Supernatural Causes, Supernatural Explanation
9. Coincidence Miracles
10. Miracle as Basic Action
11. Wittgenstein: Miracle as Gesture
12. References and Further Reading

1. The Definition of “Miracle”

In sketching out a brief philosophical discussion of miracles, it would be desirable to begin with a definition of “miracle;” unfortunately, part of the controversy in regard to miracles is over just what is involved in a proper conception of the miraculous. As a rough beginning, however, we might observe that the term is from the Latin miraculum, which is derived from mirari, to wonder; thus the most general characterization of a miracle is as an event that provokes wonder. As such, it must be in some way extraordinary, unusual, or contrary to our expectations. Disagreement arises, however, as to what makes a miracle something worth wondering about. In what sense must a miracle be extraordinary? One of the earliest accounts is given by St. Augustine, who held (City of God, XXI.8.2) that a miracle is not contrary to nature, but only to our knowledge of nature; miracles are made possible by hidden potentialities in nature that are placed there by God. In Summa Contra Gentiles III:101, St. Thomas Aquinas, expanding upon Augustine’s conception, said that a miracle must go beyond the order usually observed in nature, though he insisted that a miracle is not contrary to nature in any absolute sense, since it is in the nature of all created things to be responsive to God’s will.

In his Enquiry Concerning Human Understanding, David Hume offered two definitions of “miracle;” first, as a violation of natural law (Enquiries p. 114); shortly afterward he offers a more complex definition when he says that a miracle is “a transgression of a law of nature by a particular volition of the Deity, or by the interposition of some invisible agent” (Enquiries, p. 115n). This second definition offers two important criteria that an event must satisfy in order to qualify as a miracle: It must be a violation of natural law, but this by itself is not enough; a miracle must also be an expression of the divine will. This means that a miracle must express divine agency; if we have no reason to think that an event is something done by God, we will have no reason to call it a miracle.

More recently, the idea that a miracle must be defined in terms of natural law has come under attack. R.F. Holland (1965) has argued that a miracle may be consistent with natural law, since a religiously significant coincidence may qualify as miraculous, even though we fully understand the causes that brought it about. Accounts of the miraculous that distance themselves from the requirement that a miracle be in some way contrary to the order of nature, in favor of a focus on their significance to human life, might be said to emphasize their nature as signs; indeed the term semeion, “sign,” is one of the terms used in the New Testament to describe miraculous events.

2. Miracles and Worldview

The outcome of any discussion of miracles seems to depend greatly on our worldview. The usual theistic view of the world is one that presumes the existence of an omnipotent God who, while transcending nature, is nevertheless able to act, or to express his will, within the natural world. Clearly belief in miracles is already plausible if our enquiry may presume this view of things.

The usual way of making this out might be described as supernaturalistic. Those who would defend supernaturalism sometimes do this through a commitment to an ontology of entities that exist in some sense outside of nature, where by “nature” is meant the totality of things that can be known by means of observation and experiment, or more generally, through the methods proper to the natural sciences.

Defenses of supernaturalism may also take a methodological turn by insisting that the natural sciences are incapable of revealing the totality of all that there is. While supernaturalists typically hold that God reveals his nature in part through observable phenomena (as for example in miracles, or more generally, in the order of nature), as we shall understand it here, methodological supernaturalism is committed as well to the view that our knowledge of God must be supplemented by revelation. Revelatory sources for our knowledge of God might, for example, include some form of a priori knowledge, supersensory religious experience, or a direct communication by God of information that would not otherwise be available to us. Knowledge of God that is passed down in scripture, such as the Bible or the Qur’an, is generally conceived by theists to have a revelatory character.

Supernaturalistic accounts of the miraculous very commonly make reference to supernatural causes, which are thought to play a useful role in the construction of supernatural explanations. However, as we will see in sections 10 and 11, belief in miracles does not obviously commit one to belief in supernatural causes or the efficacy of supernatural explanations.

In contrast to supernaturalism, ontological naturalism denies the existence of anything beyond nature; methodological naturalism holds that observation and experiment—or generally speaking, the methods of the empirical sciences—are sufficient to provide us with all of the knowledge that it is possible for us to have. Naturalism is sometimes further characterized as holding that nature is uniform, which is to say that all events in nature conform to generalizations (e.g. laws) which can be verified by means of observation. Naturalists do commonly hold this view—confidence in the uniformity of nature is an important part of the scientific enterprise—but strictly speaking this represents an additional metaphysical commitment regarding the nature of the universe and its susceptibility to human understanding. If nature turns out not to be fully lawlike, this would not require the rejection of naturalism. A failure of uniformity, or what a believer in miracles might refer to as a violation of natural law, would imply only that there are limits to our ability to understand and predict natural phenomena. However, the naturalist is committed to denying the legitimacy of any attempt to explain a natural phenomenon by appeal to the supernatural. Naturalism denies the existence of supernatural entities and denies as well the claim that revelation is capable of providing us with genuine knowledge. Where the supernaturalistic worldview is quite open to the possibility of miracles, naturalism is much less sympathetic, and one might argue that the tenets of naturalism rule out the possibility of miracles altogether; see Lewis (1947:Ch. 1), Martin (1992:192) and Davis (1999:131).

Much, of course, depends on how we conceive of miracles, and on what we take their significance to be. One concern we might have with the miraculous would be an apologetic one. By “apologetic” here is meant a defense of the rationality of belief in God. Historically, apologists have pointed to the occurrence of miracles as evidence for theism, which is to say that they have held that scriptural reports of miracles, such as those given in the Bible, provide grounds for belief in God. While this argument is not as popular now as it was in the 18th century, the modern conception of the miraculous has been strongly influenced by this apologetic interest. Such an interest puts important constraints on an account of miracles. If we wish to point to a miracle as supporting belief in a supernatural deity, obviously we cannot begin by assuming the supernaturalistic worldview; this would beg the question. If we are trying to persuade a skeptic of God’s existence, we are trying to demonstrate to him that there is something beyond or transcending nature, and he will demand to be persuaded on his own terms; we must make use of no assumptions beyond those that are already acknowledged by the naturalistic worldview.

Because the history of modern thought regarding miracles has been strongly influenced by apologetic interests, the emphasis of this entry will be on the apologetic conception of the miraculous—that is, on the concept of miracle as it has been invoked by those who would point to the reports of miracles in scripture as establishing the existence of a supernatural God. It is important to bear in mind, however, that any difficulty associated with this apologetic appeal to miracles does not automatically militate against the reasonableness of belief in miracles generally. A successful criticism of the apologetic appeal will show at most that a warranted belief in miracles depends on our having independent reasons for rejecting naturalism; again, see Lewis (1947:11).

3. The Credibility of Witnesses

A major concern with the rationality of belief in miracles is with whether we can be justified in believing that a miracle has occurred on the basis of testimony. To determine whether the report of a miracle is credible, we need to consider the reliability of the source. Suppose subject S reports some state of affairs (or event) E. Are S’s reports generally true? Clearly if she is known to lie, or to utter falsehoods as jokes, we should be reluctant to believe her. Also, if she has any special interest in getting us to believe that E has occurred—if, for example, she stands to benefit financially—this would give us reason for skepticism. It is also possible that S may be reporting a falsehood without intending to do so; she may sincerely believe that E occurred even though it did not, or her report may be subject to unconscious exaggeration or distortion. Aside from the possibility that she may be influenced by some tangible self-interest, such as a financial one, her report may also be influenced by emotional factors—by her fears, perhaps, or by wishful thinking. We should also consider whether other reliable and independent witnesses are available to corroborate her report.

We must also ask whether S is herself a witness to E, or is passing on information that was reported to her. If she witnessed the event personally, we may ask a number of questions about her observational powers and the physical circumstances of her observation. There are quite a few things that can go wrong here; for example, S may sincerely report an event as she believed it to occur, but in fact her report is based on a misperception. Thus she may report having seen a man walk across the surface of a lake; this may be her understanding of what happened, when in fact he was walking alongside the lake or on a sand bar. If it was dark, and the weather was bad, this would have made it difficult for S to have a good view of what was happening. And of course we should not neglect the influence of S’s own attitudes on how she interprets what she sees; if she is already inclined to think of the man she reports as walking on water as being someone who is capable of performing such an extraordinary feat, this may color how she understands what she has seen. By the same token, if we are already inclined to agree with her about this person’s remarkable abilities, we will be all the more likely to believe her report.

If S is merely passing on the testimony of someone else to the occurrence of E, we may question whether she has properly understood what she was told. She may not be repeating the testimony exactly as it was given to her. And here, too, her own biases may color her understanding of the report. The possibility of distortions entering into testimony grows with each re-telling of the story.

It will be fruitful to consider these elements in evaluating the strength of scriptural testimony to the miracles ascribed to Jesus. The reports of these miracles come from the four gospel accounts. Some of these accounts seem to have borrowed from others, or to have been influenced by a common source; even if this were not the case, they still cannot be claimed to represent independent reports. Assuming they originate with the firsthand testimony of Jesus’ followers, these people were closely associated and had the opportunity to discuss among themselves what they had seen before their stories were recorded for posterity. They were all members of the same religious community, and shared a common perspective as well as common interests. While the gospel accounts tell us that miracles took place in front of hostile witnesses, we do not have the testimony of these witnesses. (Later acknowledgments of Jesus’ miracles by hostile parties is, the skeptic will argue, evidence only for the gullibility of these writers.)

It is sometimes suggested that these men undertook grave risk by reporting what they did, and they would not have risked their lives for a lie. But this establishes, at best, only that their reports are sincere; unfortunately, their conviction is not conclusive evidence for the truth of their testimony. We could expect the same conviction from someone who was delusional.

Let us consider a particular report of Jesus’ resurrection in applying these considerations. Popular apologetic sometimes points to the fact that according to Paul in 1 Corinthians (15:6), the resurrected Jesus was seen by five hundred people at once, and that it is highly improbable that so many people would have the experience of seeing Jesus if Jesus were not actually there. After all, it may be argued, they could not have shared a mass hallucination, since hallucinations are typically private; there is no precedent for shared hallucination, and it may seem particularly far-fetched to suppose that a hallucination would be shared among so many people. Accordingly it may be thought much more likely that Jesus really was there and, assuming there is sufficient evidence that he had died previously to that time, it becomes reasonable to say that he was resurrected from the dead.

While this report is sometimes taken as evidence of Jesus’ physical resurrection, Paul says only that he appeared to the five hundred without saying explicitly that it was a physically reconstituted Jesus that these people saw. But let us suppose that Paul means to report that the five hundred saw Jesus in the flesh. Unfortunately we do not have the reports of the five hundred to Jesus’ resurrection; we have only Paul’s hearsay testimony that Jesus was seen by five hundred. Furthermore Paul does not tell us how this information came to him. It is possible that he spoke personally to some or all of these five hundred witnesses, but it is also possible that he is repeating testimony that he received from someone else. This opens up the possibility that the report was distorted before it reached Paul; for example, the number of witnesses may have been exaggerated, or the original witnesses may have merely reported feeling Jesus’ presence in some way without actually seeing him. For the sake of argument, however, let us suppose that there was at one time a group of five hundred people who were all prepared to testify that they had seen a physically resurrected Jesus. This need not be the result of any supposed mass hallucination; the five hundred might have all seen someone who they came to believe, after discussing it amongst themselves, was Jesus. In such a case, the testimony of the five hundred would be to an experience together with a shared interpretation of it.

It is also possible that the text of Paul’s letter to the Corinthians has not been accurately preserved. Thus, no matter how reliable Paul himself might be, his own report may have been modified through one, or several, redactions.

There are, therefore, quite a few points at which error or distortion might have entered into the report in 1 Corinthians: (1) The original witnesses may have been wrong, for one reason or another, about whether they saw Jesus; (2) the testimony of these witnesses may have been distorted before reaching Paul; (3) Paul may have incorrectly reported what he heard about the event, and (4) Paul’s own report, as given in his original letter to the Christian community in Corinth, may have been distorted. The apologist may argue that it would be very surprising if errors should creep into the report at any of these four points. The question we must ask now, however, is which of these alternatives would be more surprising: That some error should arise in regard to 1-4 above, or that Jesus really was resurrected from the dead.

4. Hume’s Argument

In Section X of his Enquiry Concerning Human Understanding, Hume tells us that it is not reasonable to subscribe to any “system of religion” unless that system is validated by the occurrence of miracles; he then argues that we cannot be justified in believing that a miracle has occurred, at least when our belief is based on testimony—as when, for example, it is based on the reports of miracles that are given in scripture. (Hume did not explicitly address the question of whether actually witnessing an apparent miracle would give us good reason to think that a miracle had actually occurred, though it is possible that the principles he invokes in regard to testimony for the miraculous can be applied to the case of a witnessed miracle.) His stated aim is to show that belief in miracle reports is not rational, but that “our most holy religion is founded on Faith, not on reason” (Enquiries, p. 130). Hume surely intends some irony here, however, since he concludes by saying that anyone who embraces a belief in miracles based on faith is conscious of “a continued miracle in his own person, which subverts all the principles of his understanding” (Enquiries, p. 131); this seems very far from an endorsement of a faith-based belief in miracles.

There is some dispute as to the nature of Hume’s argument against miracles, and the Enquiry seems to contain more than one such argument. The most compelling of these is the one I will call the Balance of Probabilities Argument. (For a brief discussion of some of the other arguments, see the entry “David Hume: Writings on Religion.”) Hume tells us that we ought to proportion our certainty regarding any matter of fact to the strength of the evidence. We have already examined some of the considerations that go into assessing the strength of testimony; there is no denying that testimony may be very strong indeed when, for example, it may be given by numerous highly reliable and independent witnesses.

Nevertheless, Hume tells us that no testimony can be adequate to establish the occurrence of a miracle. The problem that arises is not so much with the reliability of the witnesses as with the nature of what is being reported. A miracle is, according to Hume, a violation of natural law. We suppose that a law of nature obtains only when we have an extensive, and exceptionless, experience of a certain kind of phenomenon. For example, we suppose that it is a matter of natural law that a human being cannot walk on the surface of water while it is in its liquid state; this supposition is based on the weight of an enormous body of experience gained from our familiarity with what happens in seas, lakes, kitchen sinks, and bathtubs. Given that experience, we always have the best possible evidence that in any particular case, an object with a sufficiently great average density, having been placed onto the surface of a body of water, will sink. According to Hume, the evidence in favor of a miracle, even when that is provided by the strongest possible testimony, will always be outweighed by the evidence for the law of nature which is supposed to have been violated.

Considerable controversy surrounds the notion of a violation of natural law. However, it would appear that all Hume needs in order to make his argument is that a miracle be an exception to the course of nature as we have previously observed it; that is, where we have had a substantial experience of a certain sort of phenomenon—call it A—and have an exceptionless experience of all As being B, we have very strong reason to believe that any given A will be a B. Thus given that we have a very great amount of experience regarding dense objects being placed onto water, and given that in every one of these cases that object has sunk, we have the strongest possible evidence that any object that is placed onto water is one that will sink. Accordingly we have the best possible reasons for thinking that any report of someone walking on water is false—and this no matter how reliable the witness.

While objections are frequently made against Hume’s conception of natural law, in fact no particularly sophisticated account of natural law seems to be necessary here, and Hume’s examples are quite commonsensical: All human beings must die, lead cannot remain suspended in the air, fire consumes wood and is extinguished by water (Enquiries p. 114). This may be a naive conception of natural law; nevertheless it is true that, all things being equal, we can assign a minimal probability to the occurrence of a counterinstance to any of these generalizations.

At times Hume sounds as though he thinks the probability of such an event is zero, given its unprecedented nature, and some commentators have objected that the fact that we have never known such an event to occur does not imply that it cannot occur. Past regularities do not establish that it is impossible that a natural law should ever be suspended (Purtill 1978). However, regardless of Hume’s original intent, this is a more extravagant claim than his argument requires. He is free to admit that some small probability may be attached to the prospect that a dense object might remain on the surface of a lake; it is sufficient for his purposes that it will always be more likely that any witness who reports such an event is attempting to deceive us, or is himself deceived. After all, there is no precedent for any human being walking on water, setting this one controversial case aside, but there is ample precedent for the falsehood of testimony even under the best of circumstances.

Accordingly Hume says (Enquiries p. 115ff) that “no testimony is sufficient to establish a miracle, unless the testimony be of such a kind, that its falsehood would be more miraculous, than the fact, which it endeavors to establish.” We must always decide in favor of the lesser miracle. We must ask ourselves, which would be more of a miracle: That Jesus walked on water, or that the scriptural reports of this event are false? While we may occasionally encounter testimony that is so strong that its falsehood would be very surprising indeed, we never come across any report, the falsehood of which would be downright miraculous. Accordingly, the reasonable conclusion will always be that the testimony is false.

Thus to return to Paul’s report of Jesus’ resurrection in 1 Corinthians: It may be highly unlikely that the original witnesses were wrong, for one reason or another, about whether they saw Jesus; it may be highly unlikely that the testimony of these witnesses may have been distorted before reaching Paul; it may be highly unlikely that Paul incorrectly reported what he heard about the event, and it may be highly unlikely that Paul’s original letter to the Christian community in Corinth has not been accurately preserved in our modern translations of the New Testament. Suppose the apologist can argue that a failure in the transmission of testimony at any of these points might be entirely without precedent in human experience. But the physical resurrection of a human being is also without precedent, so that the very best the apologist can hope for is that both alternatives—that the report is incorrect, or that Jesus returned to life—are equally unlikely, which seems only to call for a suspension of judgment. Apologetic appeals frequently focus on the strength of testimony such as Paul’s, and often appear to make a good case for its reliability. Nevertheless such an appeal will only persuade those who are already inclined to believe in the miracle—perhaps because they are already sympathetic to a supernaturalistic worldview—and who therefore tend to downplay the unlikelihood of a dead man returning to life.

Having said all this, it may strike us as odd that Hume seems not to want to rule out the possibility, in principle, that very strong testimony might establish the occurrence of an unprecedented event. He tells us (Enquiries p. 127) that if the sun had gone dark for eight days beginning on January 1, 1600, and that testimony to this fact continued to be received from all over the world and without any variation, we should believe it—and then look for the cause. Thus even if we were convinced that such an event really did take place—and the evidence in this case would be considerably stronger than the evidence for any of the miracles of the Bible—we should suppose that the event in question really had a natural cause after all. In this case the event would not be a violation of natural law, and thus according to Hume’s definition would not be a miracle.

Despite this possibility, Hume wants to say that the quality of miracle reports is never high enough to clear this hurdle, at least when they are given in the interest of establishing a religion, as they typically are. People in such circumstances are likely to be operating under any number of passional influences, such as enthusiasm, wishful thinking, or a sense of mission driven by good intentions; these influences may be expected to undermine their critical faculties. Given the importance to religion of a sense of mystery and wonder, that very quality which would otherwise tend to make a report incredible—that it is the report of something entirely novel—becomes one that recommends it to us. Thus in a religious context we may believe the report not so much in spite of its absurdity as because of it.

5. Problems with Hume’s Argument

There is something clearly right about Hume’s argument. The principle he cites surely resembles the one that we properly use when we discredit reports in tabloid newspapers about alien visitors to the White House or tiny mermaids being found in sardine cans. Nevertheless the argument has prompted a great many criticisms.

Some of this discussion makes use of Bayesian probabilistic analysis; John Earman, for example, argues that when the principles of Hume’s arguments “are made explicit and examined under the lens of Bayesianism, they are found to be either vapid, specious, or at variance with actual scientific practice” (Earman 2000). The Bayesian literature will not be discussed here, though Earman’s discussion of the power of multiple witnessing deserves mention. Earman argues that even if the prior probability of a miracle occurring is very low, if there are enough independent witnesses, and each is sufficiently reliable, its occurrence may be established as probable. Thus if Hume’s concern is to show that we cannot in principle ever have good reason to believe testimony to a miracle, he would appear to be wrong about this (Earman 2000: See particularly Ch. 18 and following). Of course the number of witnesses required might be very large, and it may be that none of the miracles reported in any scripture will qualify. It is true that some of the miracles of the Bible are reported to have occurred in the presence of a good number of witnesses; the miracle of the loaves and fishes is a good example, which according to Mark (Mark 6:30-44) was witnessed by 5,000 people. But we have already noticed that the testimony of one person, or even of four, that some event was witnessed by a multitude is not nearly the same as having the testimony of the multitude itself.

Another objection against Hume’s argument is that it makes use of a method that is unreliable; that is, it may have us reject reports that are true or accept those that are false. Consider the fact that a particular combination of lottery numbers will generally be chosen against very great odds. If the odds of the particular combination chosen in the California Lottery last week were 40 million to 1, the probability of that combination being chosen is very low. Assuming that the likelihood of any given event being misreported in the Los Angeles Times is greater than that, we would not be able to trust the Times to determine which ticket is the winner.

The unreliability objection, made out in this particular way, seems to have a fairly easy response. There is no skeptical challenge to our being justified in believing the report of a lottery drawing; that is, reports of lottery drawings are reports of ordinary events, like reports of rainstorms and presidential press conferences. They do not require particularly strong testimony to be credible, and in fact we may be justified in believing the report of a lottery drawing even if it came from an otherwise unreliable source, such as a tabloid newspaper. This is surely because we know in advance that when the lottery is drawn, whatever particular combination of numbers may be chosen will be chosen against very great odds, so that we are guaranteed to get one highly improbable combination or another. Despite the fact that the odds against any particular combination are very great, all of the other particular outcomes are equally unlikely, so we have no prejudice against any particular combination.  We know that people are going to win the lottery from time to time; we have no comparable assurance that anyone will ever be raised from the dead.

Nevertheless if we are to be able to make progress in science, we must be prepared to revise our understanding of natural law, and there ought to be circumstances in which testimony to an unprecedented event would be credible. For example, human beings collectively have seen countless squid, few of which have ever exceeded a length of two feet. For this reason reports of giant squid have, in the past, been sometimes dismissed as fanciful; the method employed by Hume in his Balance of Probabilities Argument would seem to rule out the possibility of our coming to the conclusion, on the basis of testimony, that such creatures exist—yet they have been found in the deep water near Antarctica. Similarly, someone living beyond the reach of modern technology might well reject reports of electric lighting and airplanes. Surely we should be skeptical when encountering a report of something so novel. But science depends for its progress on an ability to revise even its most confident assertions about the natural world.

Discussion of this particular problem in Hume tends to revolve around his example of the Indian and the ice. Someone from a very hot climate such as that of India, living during Hume’s time, might refuse to believe that water was capable of taking solid form as ice or frost, since he has an exceptionless experience against this. Yet in this case he would come to the wrong conclusion. Hume argues that such a person would reason correctly, and that very strong testimony would properly be required to persuade him otherwise. Yet Hume refers to this not as a miracle but as a marvel; the difference would appear to lie in the fact that while water turning to ice does not conform to the experience of the Indian, since he has experienced no precedent for this, it is also notcontrary to his experience, because he has never had a chance to see what will happen to water when the temperature is sufficiently low (Enquiries, p. 113). By the same token, we ought to be cautious when it comes to deciding how large squid may grow in the Antarctic deeps, when our only experience of them has been in warm and relatively shallow water. The circumstances of an Antarctic habitat are not analogous to those in which we normally observe squid.

On the other hand, when someone reports to us that they have witnessed a miracle, such as a human being walking on water, our experience of ordinary water is analogous to this case, and therefore counts against the likelihood that the report is true. And of course our usual experience must be analogous to this case, for if the water that someone walks upon is somehow unlike ordinary water, or there is something else in the physical circumstances that can account for how it was possible in this one instance for someone to walk on water when this is impossible in the ordinary case, then it is not a violation of natural law after all, and therefore, by Hume’s definition, not a miracle. Jesus’ walking on water will only qualify as a miracle on the assumption that this case is analogous in all relevant respects to those cases in which dense objects have sunk.

The distinction between a miracle and a marvel is an important one for Hume; as he constructs an epistemology that he hopes will rule out belief in miracles in principle, he must be careful that it does not also hinder progress in science. Whether Hume is successful in making this distinction is a matter of some controversy.

a. Does Hume’s Argument Beg the Question?

Many commentators have suggested that Hume’s argument begs the question against miracles. (See for example Lewis 1947:103, Houston 1994:133) Suppose I am considering whether it is possible for a human being to walk on water. I consider my past experience with dense objects, such as human bodies, and their behavior in water; I may even conduct a series of experiments to see what will happen when a human body is placed without support on the surface of a body of water, and I always observe these bodies to sink. I now consider what is likely to occur, or likely to have occurred, in some unknown case. Perhaps I am wondering what will happen the next time I step out into the waters of Silver Lake. Obviously I will expect, without seriously considering the matter, that I will sink rather than walk on its surface. My past experience with water gives me very good reason to think that this is what will happen. But of course in this case, I am not asking whether nature will be following its usual course. Indeed, I am assuming that it will be, since otherwise I would not refer to my past experience to judge what was likely in this particular case; my past experience of what happens with dense bodies in water is relevant only in those cases in which the uniformity of nature is not in question. But this means that to assume that our past experience is relevant in deciding what has happened in an unknown case, as Hume would have us do, is to assume that nature was following its usual course—it is to assume that there has been no break in the uniformity of nature. It is, in short, to assume that no miracle has occurred. In order to take seriously the possibility that a miracle has occurred, we must take seriously the possibility that there has been a breach in the uniformity of nature, which means that we cannot assume, without begging the question, that our ordinary observations are relevant.

It would be a mistake, however, to suppose that this criticism represents a victory for apologetic. While the apologist may wish to proceed by asking the skeptic to abandon his assumption that ordinary experience is relevant to assessing the truth of miracle reports, this seems to beg the question in the opposite direction. Ordinary experience will only fail to be relevant in those cases in which there was in fact a break in the uniformity of nature, i.e. in those cases in which a miracle has occurred, and this is precisely what the skeptic requires to be shown. It is tempting to suppose that there is a middle ground; perhaps the skeptic need only admit that it is possible that ordinary experience is not relevant in this case. However, it is difficult to determine just what sort of possibility this would be. The mere logical possibility that an exceptional event may have occurred is not something that the skeptic has ever questioned; when I infer that I will sink in the waters of Silver Lake, I do so in full recognition of the fact that it is logically possible that I will not.

If the apologist is asking for any greater concession than this, the skeptic may be forgiven for demanding that he be given some justification for granting it. He may be forgiven, too, for demanding that he be persuaded of the occurrence of a miracle on his own terms—i.e. on purely naturalistic grounds, without requiring him to adopt any of the assumptions of supernaturalism. Of course the most natural place to look for evidence that there may occasionally be breaks in the natural order would be to testimony, but for reasons that are now obvious, this will not do.

It would appear that the question of whether miracle reports are credible turns on a larger question, namely, whether we ought to hold the supernaturalistic worldview, or the naturalistic one. One thing seems certain, however, and that is that the apologist cannot depend on miracle reports to establish the supernaturalistic worldview if the credibility of such reports depends on our presumption that the supernaturalistic worldview is correct.

6. Conceptual Difficulties I: The Logical Impossibility of a Violation

Recent criticisms of belief in miracles have focused on the concept of a miracle. In particular, it has been held that the notion of a violation of natural law is self-contradictory. No one, of course, thinks that the report of an event that might be taken as a miracle—such as a resurrection or a walking on water—is logically self-contradictory. Nevertheless some philosophers have argued that it is paradoxical to suggest both that such an event has occurred, and that it is a violation of natural law. This argument dates back at least as far as T.H. Huxley, who tells us that the definition of a miracle as contravening the order of nature is self-contradictory, because all we know of the order of nature is derived from our observation of the course of events of which the so-called miracle is a part (1984:157). Should an apparent miracle take place, such as a suspension in the air of a piece of lead, scientific methodology forbids us from supposing that any law of nature has been violated; on the contrary, Huxley tells us (in a thoroughly Humean vein) that “the scientist would simply set to work to investigate the conditions under which so highly unexpected an occurrence took place; and modify his, hitherto, unduly narrow conception of the laws of nature” (1894:156). More recently this view has been defended by Antony Flew (1966, 1967, 1997) and Alastair McKinnon (1967). McKinnon has argued that in formulating the laws of nature, the scientist is merely trying to codify what actually happens; thus to claim that some event is a miracle, where this is taken to imply that it is a violation of natural law, is to claim at once that it actually occurred, but also, paradoxically, that it is contrary to the actual course of events.

Let us say that a statement of natural law is a generalization of the form “All As are Bs;” for example, all objects made of lead (A) are objects that will fall when we let go of them (B). A violation would be represented by the occurrence of an A that is not a B, or in this case, an object made of lead that does not fall when we let go of it. Thus to assert that a violation of natural law has occurred is to say at once that all As are Bs, but to say at the same time that there exists some A that is not a B; it is to say, paradoxically, that all objects made of lead will fall when left unsupported, but that this object made of lead did not fall when left unsupported. Clearly we cannot have it both ways; should we encounter a piece of lead that does not fall, we will be forced to admit that it is not true that all objects made of lead will fall. On McKinnon’s view, a counterinstance to some statement of natural law negates that statement; it shows that our understanding of natural law is incorrect and must be modified—which implies that no violation has occurred after all.

Of course this does not mean that no one has ever parted the Red Sea, walked on water, or been raised from the dead; it only means that such events, if they occurred, cannot be violations of natural law. Thus arguably, this criticism does not undermine the Christian belief that these events really did occur (Mavrodes 1985:337). But if Antony Flew is correct (1967:148), for the apologist to point to any of these events as providing evidence for the existence of a transcendent God or the truth of a particular religious doctrine, we must not only have good reason to believe that they occurred, but also that they represent an overriding of natural law, an overriding that originates from outside of nature. To have any apologetic value, then, a miracle must be a violation of natural law, which means that we must (per impossibile) have both the law and the exception.

a. Violations as Nonrepeatable Counterinstances to Natural Law

The conception of a violation may, however, be defended as logically coherent. Suppose we take it to be a law of nature that a human being cannot walk on water; subsequently, however, we become convinced that on one particular occasion (O)—say for example, April 18th, 1910—someone was actually able to do this. Yet suppose that after the occurrence of O water goes back to behaving exactly as it normally does. In such a case our formulation of natural law would continue to have its usual predictive value, and surely we would neither abandon it nor revise it. The only revision possible in this case would be to say “Human beings cannot walk on water, except on occasion O.” Yet the amendment in this case is entirely ad hoc; in its reference to a particular event, the revision fails to take the generalized form that statements of natural law normally possess, and it adds no explanatory power to the original formulation of the law. It gives us no better explanation of what has happened in the past, it does nothing to account for the exceptional event O, and it fares no better than the original formulation when it comes to predicting what will happen in the future. In this case O is what might be called a nonrepeatable counterinstance to natural law. Faced with such an event we would retain our old formulation of the law, which is to say that the exceptional event O does not negate that formulation. This means that there is no contradiction implied by affirming the law together with its exception.

Things would be different if we can identify some feature (F) of the circumstances in which O occurred which will explain why O occurred in this one case when normally it would not. F might be some force operating to counteract the usual tendency of a dense object, such as a human body, to sink in water. In this case, on discovery of F we are in a position to reformulate the law in a fruitful way, saying that human beings cannot walk on water except when F is present. Since the exception in this case now has a generalized form (i.e. it expresses the proposition that human beings can walk on water whenever F is present), our reformulation has the kind of generality that a statement of natural law ought to have. It explains the past interaction of dense bodies with water as well as the original formulation did, and it explains why someone was able to walk on water on occasion O. Finally, it will serve to predict what will happen in the future, both when F is absent and when it is present.

We may now, following Ninian Smart (1964:37) and Richard Swinburne (1970:26), understand a violation as a nonrepeatable counterinstance to natural law. We encounter a nonrepeatable counterinstance when someone walks on water, as in case O, and having identified all of the causally relevant factors at work in O, and reproducing these, no one is able to walk on water. Since a statement of natural law is falsified only by the occurrence of a repeatable counterinstance, it is paradoxical to assert a particular statement of law and at the same time insist that a repeatable counterinstance to it has occurred. However there is no paradox in asserting the existence of the law together with the occurrence of a counterinstance that is not repeatable.

b. Miracles as Outside the Scope of Natural Laws

The force of this line of reasoning is to deny that natural laws must describe the actual course of events. Natural laws do not describe absolutely the limits of what can and cannot happen in nature. They only describe nature to the extent that it operates according to laws. To put the matter differently, we might say that natural laws only describe what can happen as a result of natural causes; they do not tell us what can happen when a supernatural cause is present. As Michael Levine (1989:67) has put the point:

Suppose the laws of nature are regarded as nonuniversal or incomplete in the sense that while they cover natural events, they do not cover, and are not intended to cover, non-natural events such as supernaturally caused events if there are or could be any. A physically impossible occurrence would not violate a law of nature because it would not be covered by (i.e. would not fall within the scope of) such a law.

On this understanding, a physically impossible event would be one that could not occur given only physical, or natural, causes. But what is physically impossible is not absolutely impossible, since such an event might occur as the result of a supernatural cause. One way to make this out is to say that all laws must ultimately be understood as disjunctions, of the form “All As are Bs unless some supernatural cause is operating.” (Let us refer to this as a supernaturalistic formulation of law, where of course it is causal supernaturalism that is at work here, as opposed to a naturalistic formulation, which simply asserts that all As are Bs, without taking account the possibility of any supernatural cause.) If this is correct, then it turns out that strictly speaking, a miracle is not a violation of natural law after all, since it is something that occurs by means of a supernatural intervention. Furthermore, since statements of natural law are only intended to describe what happens in the absence of supernatural intrusions, the occurrence of a miracle does not negate any formulation of natural law.

The supernaturalistic conception of natural law appears to offer a response to Hume’s Balance of Probabilities argument; the evidence for natural laws, gathered when supernatural causes are absent, does not weigh against the possibility that a miracle should occur, since a miracle is the result of a supernatural intervention into the natural order. Thus there is a failure of analogy between those cases that form the basis for our statements of natural law, and the circumstances of a miracle. Probabilistic considerations, based on our ordinary experience, are only useful in determining what will happen in the ordinary case, when there are no supernatural causes at work.

7. Conceptual Difficulties II: Identifying Miracles

We have seen two ways in which the concept of a miracle, described as an event that nature cannot produce on its own, may be defended as coherent. We may say that a miracle is a violation of natural law and appeal to the conception of a violation as a nonrepeatable counterinstance, or we may deny that miracles are violations of natural law since, having supernatural causes, they fall outside the scope of these laws. Nevertheless, conceptual difficulties remain. Antony Flew (1966, 1967, 1997) has argued that if a miracle is to serve any apologetic purpose, as evidence for the truth of some revelation, then it must be possible to identify it as a miracle without appealing to criteria given by that revelation; in particular, there must be natural, or observable, criteria by which an event can be determined to be one which nature cannot produce on its own. Flew refers to this as the Problem of Identifying Miracles.

Let us see how this problem arises in connection with these two conceptions of the miraculous. Are there natural criteria by which we can distinguish a repeatable from a nonrepeatable counterinstance to some natural law? Suppose some formulation of natural law (All As are Bs) and some event that is a counterinstance to that formulation (an A that is not a B). The counterinstance will be repeatable just in case there is some natural force F present in the circumstances that is causally responsible for the counterinstance, such that every time F is present, a similar counterinstance will occur. But suppose we do our best to reproduce the circumstances of the event and are unable to do so. We cannot assume that the event is nonrepeatable, for we have no way to eliminate the possibility that we have failed to identify all of the natural forces that were operating to produce the original counterinstance. The exceptional event may have been produced by a natural force that is unknown to us. No observable distinction can be made between a case in which an exception is repeatable, having been produced by some as-yet undiscovered natural force, and one that is not. Worse yet, the naturalist will argue that the very occurrence of the exception is evidence that there is in fact some previously unknown natural force at work; where there is a difference in effects, there must be a difference in causes—which for the naturalist means, of course, natural causes.

Nor does the difficulty go away if we adopt the supernaturalistic view of natural law. On this view, natural laws only describe what happens when supernatural forces are absent; a genuine miracle does not violate natural law because it is the effect of a supernatural cause. Suppose an extraordinary event occurs, which the apologist would like to attribute to a supernatural cause. The following two states of affairs appear to be empirically indistinguishable:

1. The event is the result of a natural cause that we are as yet unable to identify.

2. The event is the result of a supernatural cause.

This, of course, is due to the fact that we do not observe the cause of the event in either of these cases—in the first, it is because the cause is unknown to us, and in the second, because supernatural causes are unobservable ex hypothesi. Thus the issue here is whether we should suppose that our failure to observe any cause for the event is due to our (perhaps temporary) inability to fully identify all of the natural forces that were operating to produce it, or whether it is because the cause, being supernatural, is in principle unobservable. If Flew is right, then in order to identify the event as a miracle, we must find some way to rule out the possibility of ever finding a natural cause for it; furthermore, if the identification of this event as a miracle is to serve any apologetic purpose, we must find some empirical grounds for doing this.

To complicate matters even further, there is yet a third possibility, which is that:

3. The event has no cause at all.

That is, it is possible that the event is simply uncaused or spontaneous. It is clear that there can be no observable difference between an event that has a supernatural cause, since such a cause is in principle unobservable, and one that fails to have a cause. The challenge for an account of miracles as supernaturally caused is to show what the difference is between conceiving an event as having a supernatural cause, and conceiving of it as simply lacking any cause at all.

The implications of this are quite significant: Even if the naturalist were forced to admit that an event had no natural cause, and that nature is, therefore, not fully lawlike, this does not commit him to supernaturalism. It is possible that nature undergoes spontaneous lapses in its uniformity. Such events would be nonrepeatable counterinstances to natural law, but they would not be miracles. They would fall within the unaided potentialities of nature; the naturalist need not admit the necessity of supernatural intervention to produce such events, because their occurrence requires no appeal to any transcendent reality. Indeed, should we become persuaded that an event has occurred that has no natural cause, the naturalist may argue that simplicity dictates that we forgo any appeal to the supernatural, since this would involve the introduction of an additional entity (God) without any corresponding benefit in explanatory power.

8. Supernatural Causes and Supernatural Explanation

The apologist, however, will insist that this is precisely the point. Describing an extraordinary event as the effect of a supernatural cause, and attributing it to divine intervention, is justified by the fact that it offers us a chance to explain it where no natural explanation is available. Assuming (as the naturalist typically does) that nature operates according to physical laws, the occurrence of an apparent exception points to some difference in the circumstances. If no difference in the physical circumstances can be found, then the only explanation available is that there is some supernatural force at work. It is unreasonable to reject such a supernatural explanation in the purely speculative hope that one day a natural explanation may become available.

The notion of a supernatural explanation deserves careful attention. The naturalist will surely argue that the conception of a supernatural explanation—together with its cognate, the notion of a supernatural cause—is confused. This position is motivated by the conviction that the notions of an explanation and of a cause are fundamentally empirical conceptions.

First, as regards the conception of a cause: Paradigmatically, causation is a relation between two entities, a cause (or some set of causal circumstances) and an effect. Now there are many cases in which we witness the effect of a cause that is not seen; I might for example hear the sound of a gunshot, and not see the gun that produced it. Furthermore I will be able to infer that there is a gun somewhere nearby that produced that sound. This is an inference from effect to cause, and is similar to what the apologist would like to do with a miracle, inferring the existence of God (as cause) from the occurrence of the miracle (as effect). But what makes my inference possible in this case is, as Hume would point out, the fact that I have observed a regular conjunction of similar causes with similar effects. This is precisely what is lacking when it comes to supernatural causes. I cannot ever experience the conjunction of a supernatural cause with its effect, since supernatural causes are (by hypothesis) unobservable—nor can I make an inference from any phenomenon in nature to its supernatural cause without such an experience. Indeed given the very uniqueness of God’s miraculous interventions into nature, it is difficult to see how the notion of divine causation could draw on any kind of regularity at all, as empirical causes do.

It is true that science often appeals to invisible entities such as electrons, magnetic fields, and black holes; perhaps the apologist conceives her own appeal as having a similar character (Geivett 1997:183). These things, one may argue, are known only through their observable effects. But the causal properties of such natural entities as electrons and magnetic fields are analogous to those of entities that are observable; this is what entitles us to refer to them as natural entities. Furthermore, these properties may be described in terms of observable regularities, which means that entities like electrons and magnetic fields may play a role in theories that have predictive power. Thus for example, an appeal to electrons can help us predict what will happen when we turn on a light switch. God is not a theoretical entity of this kind. Far from being able to play a role in any empirical regularities, God’s miraculous interventions into nature, as these are conceived by the supernaturalist, are remarkable for their uniqueness.

Another reason for doubting that God can possess causal powers analogous to those enjoyed by natural objects arises from the fact that God is typically conceived as lacking any location in space—and on the view of some philosophers, as being outside of time as well. Causal relationships among natural entities play out against a spatio-temporal background. Indeed it would seem that to speak of God as the cause of events in nature encounters something similar to the Problem of Mind-Body Interaction. (This should not be surprising given the usual conception of God as a nonmaterial entity, i.e. as mind or spirit.) All of the cases of causal interaction of which we are aware occur between physical entities that are fundamentally similar to one another in terms of possessing physical properties such as mass, electrical charge, location in space etc. Thus we know for example how one billiard ball may move another by virtue of the transfer of momentum. But God possesses none of these qualities, and cannot therefore interact with physical objects in any way that we can understand. God cannot, for example, transfer momentum to a physical object if God does not possess mass.

It may be argued that the conception of an explanation is inextricably intertwined with that of causation, so that if the conception of a supernatural cause is an empty one, the notion of a supernatural explanation can hardly be expected to get off the ground. The apologist may respond by distinguishing the sort of explanation she intends to give, when she attributes a miracle to divine agency, from the sort of explanation that is common to the natural sciences. In particular, she might characterize them as personal explanations, which work to explain a phenomenon by reference to the intentions of an agent—in this case God. (See for example Swinburne 1979: Ch. 2) Now, it is true that personal explanations do not have quite the same empirical basis as do scientific ones; nevertheless, like scientific explanations, they do typically have empirical consequences. For example, if I explain Bertrand’s running a red light by saying that he wanted to be on time to his meeting, I have given a personal explanation for Bertrand’s behavior, and it is one that is testable. It will be supported by any observations that tend to confirm the hypothesis that Bertrand is due for a meeting and that being on time is something that he desires, and it will be undermined by any that are contrary to it, such as discovering that Bertrand does not believe that any meeting is imminent. Furthermore this explanation also serves as a basis for rough predictions about other actions that Bertrand might be expected to perform, e.g. he will likely take other steps (possibly involving additional traffic violations) in order to make it to his meeting on time.

The most obvious way in which appeals to divine agency fail to be analogous to the usual sort of personal explanation is in their failure to yield even the vaguest of predictions. (See Nowell-Smith 1955) Suppose, for example, that we attribute a walking on water to divine intervention; from this description, nothing follows about what we can expect to happen in the future. Unless we can introduce additional information provided by revelation, we have no grounds for inferring that God will bring it about that additional miracles will occur; he may, or he may not. Indeed, as far as this kind of predictive expansion is concerned, we seem no better off saying that some event came about because God willed it to occur than we would be if we said of it simply that it had no cause, or that it occurred spontaneously. (Indeed, often when someone says “It was God’s will,” they are calling attention to the inscrutability of events.) In light of this fact, there is no reason why the naturalist should find such a supernatural explanation compelling; on the contrary, faced with a putative miracle, if his concern was to explain the event, he would be justified in following Hume’s advice and continuing to hold out for a natural cause and a natural explanation—one that possesses predictive power—or in the worst case, to simply shrug off the incident as inexplicable, while denying that this inexplicability warrants any appeal to the divine.

An objection here may be that all of this makes use of an unnecessarily narrow conception of causation—one which arbitrarily seeks to restrict their use to the natural sciences. Undoubtedly the word “cause” is used in a very diverse number of ways, and it is surely wrong to say that no sense can ever be attached to a statement of the form “God caused x to occur.” The same may be said regarding the notion of an explanation. But it is the apologist who tries to understand supernatural causes as analogous to the sort of causes that are of interest to natural science. If supernatural causes are not sufficiently similar to natural ones, they cannot be expected to fill the gap when natural causes are found to be lacking.

The most fundamental challenge to someone who wishes to appeal to the existence of supernatural causes is to make it clear just what the difference is between saying that an event has a supernatural cause, and saying that it has no cause at all. Similarly when it comes to the prospect of giving a supernatural explanation: Supposing that someone walks on water and we are unable to find any natural explanation for this, what warrants our saying that such an event has a supernatural explanation, as opposed to saying that it is inexplicable and being done with it?

9. Coincidence Miracles

Given the difficulties that arise in connection with the suggestion that God causes a miracle to occur, a non-causal account deserves consideration. R.F. Holland (1965) has suggested that a religiously significant coincidence may qualify as a miracle. Suppose a child who is riding a toy motor-car gets stuck on the track at a train crossing. A train is approaching from around a curve, and the engineer who is driving it will not be able to see the child until it is too late to stop. By coincidence, the engineer faints at just the right moment, releasing his hand on the control lever, which causes the train to stop automatically. The child, against all expectations, is saved, and his mother thanks God for his providence; she continues to insist that a miracle has occurred even after hearing the explanation of how the train came to stop when it did. Interestingly, when the mother attributes the stopping of the train to God she is not identifying God as its cause; the cause of the train’s stopping is the engineer’s fainting. Nor is she, in any obvious way, offering an explanation for the event—at least none that is intended to compete with the naturalistic explanation made possible by reference to the engineer’s medical condition. What makes this event a miracle, if it is, is its significance, which is given at least in part by its being an apparent response to a human need.

Like a violation miracle, such a coincidence occurs contrary to our expectations, yet it does this without standing in opposition to our understanding of natural law. To conceive of such an event as a miracle does seem to satisfy the notion of a miracle as an event that elicits wonder, though the object of our wonder seems not so much to be how the train came to stop as the simple fact that it should stop when it did, when we had every reason to think it would not.

A similar account of the miraculous comes from John Hick’s conception of religious faith as a form of “experiencing-as.” Inspired by Wittgenstein‘s discussion of seeing-as in the Philosophical Investigations (194e), Hick has argued that while the theist and the atheist live in the same physical environment, they experience it differently; the theist sees a significance in the events of her life that prompts her to describe her experience as a continuing interaction with God (1973:Ch. 2). A theist, for example, might benefit from an unexpected job opportunity and experience this as an expression of divine providence; the same event might not move an atheist in this way. Regarding miracles in particular, Hick (1973:51) writes:

A miracle, whatever else it may be, is an event through which we become vividly and immediately conscious of God as acting towards us. A startling happening, even if it should involve a suspension of natural law, does not constitute for us a miracle in the religious sense of the word if it fails to make us intensely aware of God’s presence. In order to be miraculous, an event must be experienced as religiously significant.

Holland gives no indication that he wants to describe the miracle of the train in terms of experiencing-as. Nevertheless it seems reasonable to say, with Hick, that in Holland’s example, while the child’s mother has seen the same thing that the skeptic has—the stopping of the train—she understands it differently, experiencing it as a miracle, and as an expression of divine providence.

But now a new problem emerges: If the question of whether an event is a miracle lies in its significance, and if its significance is a matter of how we understand it, then it is hard to see how the determination that some event is a miracle can avoid being an entirely subjective matter. In this case, whether or not a miracle has occurred depends on how the witnesses see it, and so (arguably) is more a fact about the witnesses, and their response to the event, than it is to the event itself. (See Smart 1964:35) But we do not typically analyze human agency in this way; whether or not Caesar crossed the Rubicon is not a matter of how anyone experiences things. The question of whether Caesar crossed the Rubicon is an objective one. Surely the theist wishes to say that the question of whether God has acted in the world, in the occurrence of a miracle, is objective as well. And surely this fact accounts for the attractiveness of a causal account of miracles; any dispute over the cause of a putative miracle is a dispute over the facts, not a dispute about how people view the facts.

10. Miracle as Basic Action

This is a serious criticism, but it overlooks something very important about the character of actions generally. To ask whether a human being has acted is surely to ask an objective question, but it is not always to ask a question about causes. Arthur Danto (1965) has argued for a distinction between two types of action: Those that are mediated, and those that are basic. (See also Davidson 1982, who refers to basic actions as primitive.)  I act in a mediated way when I perform action x by doing y; for example, if I turn on the light in my study by flicking a switch, my turning on the light is a mediated action. My flicking the switch is also a mediated action if I flick the switch by moving my fingers.  Notice that, when we say that I turned on the light in a mediated sort of way, this may carry causal implications: In this case, the light’s coming on was caused by the switch’s being flicked, and the switch’s being flicked was caused by my fingers’ moving.  But not all of our actions are like this. When I move my fingers in order to flip the switch, I do not bring about their movement by doing anything else; I just move them. Thus to say I have acted in moving my fingers does not imply that I caused anything to happen. Yet clearly it is, in some sense of “fact,” a fact that I moved my fingers.

It is possible, of course, that my fingers’ moving has a cause, such as the firing of various neurons. But my neural firings are not actions of mine; they are not things that I do. It is not as though I set about to fire my neurons as part of a procedure aimed ultimately at bringing it about that my muscles contract and my fingers move. And even if I did, there would have to be something that I did immediately in order to set the chain of causes going, or there would be an infinite series of actions I would have to perform in order to turn on the light—I could never so much as start to act . Thus the possibility of being able to describe my fingers’ moving in terms of physical causes, and of thereby being able to give a natural explanation for this in terms of neural firings and the like, does not rule out the possibility of saying that in moving my fingers, I have acted.

Some philosophers believe that the truth of a libertarian account of free will implies that the free actions of human beings have no natural cause. This parallels the way that the traditional view of miracles has understood the manner of God’s action in a miracle. (J.P. Moreland has discussed the analogy between free human actions and miracles in this regard; see Moreland 1997.) Such a libertarian view of human action may be correct. It is important to recognize, however, that we do not have to settle the matter; we do not have to show that someone’s moving of their fingers has no natural cause in order to attribute this movement to their agency. Thus analogously, a believer in miracles may insist that there is no natural explanation for various miracles such as the creation of the universe, Moses’ parting of the Red Sea, or Jesus’ resurrection. But if miracles are basic actions on the part of God, then our attribution of divine agency to such events does not require us to show that these things cannot be explained by reference to natural causes. Whatever we must do to identify an event as a miracle, if a miracle is conceived as a basic action on the part of God, it cannot involve a requirement to show that it has no natural cause.

To ascribe a basic action to its agent is not to make any claim about its cause; thus if miracles are properly conceived as basic actions on the part of God, it is not the case that “any assertion that a miracle has occurred is implicitly a causal assertion” (Levine 1994:39), though this view is widely held. On the contrary, the ascription of a miracle to God will be logically independent of any causal analysis. (For a detailed discussion of this point see Corner 2007, and particularly Ch. 4.)

11. Wittgenstein: Miracle as Gesture

This leaves open the question of how we are to identify an event as a miracle, if this does not involve a causal analysis.  One approach is to think of a miracle as a gesture on the part of God. In Culture and Value (1980:45e), Ludwig Wittgenstein writes:

A miracle is, as it were, a gesture that God makes. As a man sits quietly and then makes an impressive gesture, God lets the world run on smoothly and then accompanies the words of a saint by a symbolic occurrence, a gesture of nature. It would be an instance if, when a saint has spoken, the trees around him bowed, as if in reverence.

It is interesting that Wittgenstein should speak of a gesture as a symbolic occurrence. A human bodily movement becomes a gesture when it takes on a particular kind of significance. The significance of a bow, for example, lies in the fact that it is an expression of reverence or respect. Being able to identify a bending at the waist as a bow requires us to be familiar with the culture in which this particular bodily movement has the significance that it does. Nevertheless, the question of whether someone has bowed is an objective one—it is, we might say, a question about the facts. Thus the analogy of a miracle to a gesture may give us a way to view miracles at once as signs, allowing us to say that the character of a miracle lies, at least in part, in its significance within what Wittgenstein would call a “form of life,” and at the same time insist that the question of its significance is an objective matter.

If a miracle is like a gesture in the way Wittgenstein thinks it is, then supposing that a miraculous event should occur, part of what makes it possible to identify that event as a miracle is an appreciation of its significance. But a miracle does not take on its significance in a vacuum; the significance of a miracle, like the significance of a gesture, is dependent on a certain sort of context. This context is established, at least to some degree, by one’s view of the world; whether one is able to identify an event as a miracle will depend on one’s ability to integrate it with a worldview in which the possibility of God’s acting in nature is already acknowledged. Such a limitation poses no problem for theology generally, which might legitimately regard such a view of things as its starting point. It will, however, be fatal to any apologetic appeal that seeks to establish the credentials of theistic religion by pointing to the occurrence of a putative miracle and attempting to establish, on grounds that are consistent with naturalism, that this event gives compelling evidence for the existence of God.

Peter Winch has recently taken up Wittgenstein’s comparison of a miracle to a gesture:

A certain disposition, or movement, of a human body can be called a ‘gesture’ only within a context where it is possible for it to be recognised and/or reacted to as a gesture… Such a possibility depends, at least in large part, on the reigning culture within which the action occurs. (1995:211, emphasis in the original)

Winch observes that our recognition of a gesture is typically immediate rather than inferred. Thus for example, if we are introduced to someone and they bow, we would not normally arrive at the conclusion that they are bowing by means of an inference, after first eliminating the possibility that their movement has a natural explanation; on the contrary, if we are sufficiently familiar with bowing as a cultural institution we will immediately recognize the character of their act. Furthermore, our recognition of the fact that they have bowed will typically be shown in our reaction to their gesture, e.g. in our bowing in return. Analogously, we express our recognition of a miracle not by looking to see if it has any natural cause, but by responding in the manner characteristic of theistic religion; with awe, perhaps, or with gratitude for God’s beneficence. (This is the response of the mother in Holland’s miracle of the train.) But, just as our ability to recognize, and to react appropriately to, a bow depends on our being immersed in a particular culture, so might our ability to recognize a miracle and react to it in the characteristically religious way. If Winch is correct, then the skeptic, who seeks to show that a putative miracle has a natural cause, is proceeding in the wrong direction—but then so is the theist who tries to show that the event cannot be explained scientifically. Such a theist commits the same error as one would who thinks that in order to show that a particular gesture is a bow, we must show that no physiological explanation can be given for it.

The mainstream theistic approach to miracles is, at the moment, one that would prefer to employ a method similar to that used in the natural sciences. Philosophers taking this approach are unlikely to be satisfied with the conception of a miracle as a gesture. But if Winch is right, this is an indication of how deeply embedded science has become in modern western culture, and an indication as well of a drift away from the kind of religious culture in which the conception of a miracle originally found its home.

12. References and Further Reading

• Aquinas, Thomas, Summa Contra Gentiles, III:100-103
• Augustine, The City of God, XXI:8
• Beardsmore, R.W, “Hume and the Miraculous,” Religions and Hume’s Legacy, ed. Phillips, D.Z. and Tessin, Timothy, Claremont Studies in the Philosophy of Religion, New York: St. Martin’s Press
• Corner, David (2007), The Philosophy of Miracles, London: Continuum
• Danto, Arthur C. (1965), “Basic Actions,” American Philosophical Quarterly, 2:141-8
• Davidson, Donald (1982), Essays on Action and Events, New York: Oxford University Press
• Davis, Stephen T (1999), “Beardsmore on Hume on Miracles,” Religions and Hume’s Legacy, ed. Phillips, D.Z. and Tessin, Timothy, Claremont Studies in the Philosophy of Religion, New York: St. Martin’s Press
• Earman, John (2000), Hume’s Abject Failure: The Argument Against Miracles, New York: Oxford University Press
• Hume, David (1975), Enquiries Concerning Human Understanding, Ed. L.A. Selby-Bigge 3rd ed. Oxford: Oxford University Press
• Flew, Anthony (1966), God and Philosophy, New York: Harcourt, Brace and World
• Flew, Anthony (1967), “Miracles,” Encyclopedia of Philosophy. New York: Macmillan and Free Press, 1967, vol. 5, pp. 346-353
• Flew, Anthony (1997), Hume’s Philosophy of Belief, Bristol: Thoemmes Press
• Fogelin, Robert J. (2003), A Defense of Hume on Miracles, Princeton: Princeton University Press
• Geivett, R. Douglas (1997), “The Evidential Value of Miracles,” in Geivett, R. Douglas and Habermas, Gary R. eds (1997), In Defense of Miracles: A Comprehensive Case for God’s Action in History, Downers Grove: Intervarsity Press
• Hick, John (1973), God and the Universe of Faiths, Oxford: Oneworld Publications Ltd.
• Holland, R.F. (1965), “The Miraculous,” American Philosophical Quarterly 2:43-51
• Houston, J. (1994), Reported Miracles, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press
• Huxley, T.H., (1894) Collected Essays, Vol. VI, Hume:, With Helps to the Study of Berkeley, New York: D. Appleton and Company
• Lewis, C.S. (1947), Miracles, New York: Macmillan
• Levine, Michael, P. (1989), Hume and the Problem of Miracles: A Solution, Dordrecht: Kluwer Publishers
• Locke, John (2000), A Discourse of Miracles, in Earman, John, Hume’s Abject Failure: The Argument Against Miracles, New York: Oxford University Press
• Mackie. J.L. (1982), The Miracle of Theism: Arguments for and against the Existence of God New York: Oxford University Press
• Martin, Michael (1992), Atheism: A Philosophical Justification, Philadelphia: Temple University Press
• Mavrodes, George I. (1985), “Miracles and the Laws of Nature,” Faith and Philosophy, Vol. 2 No. 4, October 1985
• McKinnon, Alastair (1967), “Miracle’ and ‘Paradox,” American Philosophical Quarterly, 4:308-314
• Moore, Gareth (1996), Believing in God, Edinburgh: T & T Clark
• Nowell-Smith, Patrick (1955), “Miracles,” in New Essays in Philosophical Theology, ed. Antony Flew and Alastair MacIntyre, New York: Macmillan
• Melden, A.I. (1961), Free Action, London: Routledge & Kegan Paul
• Moreland, J.P (1997), “Science, Miracles, Agency Theory & the God-of-the-Gaps,” in Geivett, R. Douglas and Habermas, Gary R. eds (1997), In Defense of Miracles: A Comprehensive case for God’s Action in History,Downers Grove: Intervarsity Press
• Purtill, Richard (1978), “Thinking about Religion: A Philosophical Introduction to Religion,” Prentice-Hall
• Smart, Ninian (1964), Philosophers and Religious Truth, New York: Macmillan
• Swinburne, Richard (1970), The Concept of Miracle, London: Macmillan
• Swinburne, Richard (1979), The Existence of God, Oxford: Clarendon Press
• Swinburne, Richard ed. (1989), Miracles, from the series Philosophical Topics ed. Paul Edwards, New York: Macmillan
• Winch, Peter (1995), “Asking Too Many Questions,” in Tessin, Timothy and von der Ruhr, Mario eds, Philosophy and the Grammar of Religious Belief, Claremont Studies in the Philosophy of Religion, New York: St. Martin’s Press.
• Wittgenstein, Ludwig (1958), Philosophical Investigations, 3rd edition, tr. G.E.M. Anscombe, Basil Blackwell & Mott, Ltd.
• Wittgenstein, Ludwig (1980), Culture and Value, tr. Peter Winch, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.

Author Information

David Corner
Email: dcorner@csus.edu
California State University Sacramento
U. S. A.