Contextualism in Epistemology

In very general terms, epistemological contextualism maintains that whether one knows is somehow relative to context. Certain features of contexts—features such as the intentions and presuppositions of the members of a conversational context—shape the standards that one must meet in order for one’s beliefs to count as knowledge. This allows for the possibility that different contexts set different epistemic standards, and contextualists invariably maintain that the standards do in fact vary from context to context. In some contexts, the epistemic standards are unusually high, and it is difficult, if not impossible, for our beliefs to count as knowledge in such contexts. In most contexts, however, the epistemic standards are comparatively low, and our beliefs can and often do count as knowledge in these contexts. The primary arguments for epistemological contextualism claim that contextualism best explains our epistemic judgments—it explains why we judge in most contexts that we have knowledge and why we judge in some contexts that we don’t—and that contextualism provides the best solution to puzzles generated by skeptical arguments.

Table of Contents

1. Introduction
2. Subjunctive Conditionals Contextualism
3. Relevant Alternatives Contextualism and Rejecting Closure
   1. Dretske’s Relevant Alternatives Theory of Knowledge
   2. Relevant Alternatives Contextualisms that Reject Closure
4. Relevant Alternatives Contextualism and Accepting Closure
5. Contextualism and Epistemic Rationality
6. Other Forms of Epistemological Contextualism
   1. Explanatory Contextualism
   2. Evidential Contextualism
   3. Contextualism as a Theory of Knowledge
7. Objections to Contextualism
8. Alternatives to Contextualism
9. Conclusion
10. References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

Epistemological contextualism has evolved primarily as a response to views that maintain that we have no knowledge of the world around us. Taking quite seriously the problems presented by skepticism, contextualists seek to resolve the apparent conflict between claims like the following:

1. I know that I have hands.
2. But I don’t know that I have hands if I don’t know that I’m not a brain-in-a-vat (that is, a bodiless brain that is floating in a vat of nutrients and that is electrochemically stimulated in a way that generates perceptual experiences that are exactly similar to those that I am now having in what I take to be normal circumstances).
3. I don’t know that I’m not a brain-in-a-vat (henceforth, a BIV).

These claims, when taken together, present a puzzle. (1), (2), and (3) are independently plausible yet mutually inconsistent. That (1) is plausible seems to require no explanation. (3) is plausible because it seems that in order to know that I’m not a BIV, I must rule out the possibility that I am a BIV. Yet the BIV and I have perceptual experiences that are exactly similar—it seems to the BIV, just as it seems to me, that he has hands, that he is sitting at his desk and in front of his computer, and so on. Accordingly, my perceptual experiences give me no reason to favor the belief that I am not a BIV over the belief that I am. Thus, since I have only my perceptual experiences to go on, I cannot rule out the possibility that I’m a BIV. Considerations like these contribute to (3)’s plausibility.

Moreover, it seems that I can’t know that I have hands—and, in general, that I can’t know that I have any body at all —if I can’t rule out the possibility that I’m a bodiless BIV. This, then, contributes to the plausibility of (2). It seems in addition that (2) always retains its plausibility, no matter how high or low we set the standards for knowledge. Keith DeRose (1999a) defends this claim by noting that it is always a comparative fact that my epistemic position with respect to the claim that I’m not a BIV is just as strong as my epistemic position with respect to the claim that I have hands. If this is correct, then (2) is true across contexts, no matter what the epistemic standards.

Yet in spite of the fact that they are independently plausible, (1), (2), and (3) are mutually inconsistent; they cannot all be true. It seems, therefore, that we must give up one of these claims. But which one should we give up, and why?

In trying to answer these questions, contextualists maintain that ‘know’ either is or functions very much like an indexical, that is, an expression whose semantic content (or meaning) depends on the context of its use. For example, the word ‘here’ is an indexical. I say, “Jaime is here,” and what I mean depends on where I am when I say it. If I’m in the conference room, then I mean, all other things being equal, that Jaime is in the conference room. ‘I’ is also an indexical—its meaning depends on the context of its use and, in particular, on who is using it. When Jaime says, “I am in the conference room,” then he means, all other things being equal, that Jaime is in the conference room. Yet when Julie uses ‘I’, she means something different; Julie’s ‘I’ means Julie.

If ‘know’ is an indexical, its semantic content (or meaning) will depend on the context in which it is used. Furthermore, since context will affect the semantic content of ‘know’, context will have an effect on the semantic content of complex lexical items in which ‘know’ appears, for example, on the semantic content of knowledge attributions like ‘Jaime knows that he’s in the conference room’. Contextualists have put the point this way:

the truth-conditions of knowledge ascribing and knowledge denying sentences (sentences of the form ‘S knows that P’ and ‘S doesn’t know that P’ and related variants of such sentences) vary in certain ways according to the contexts in which they are uttered. What so varies is the epistemic standards that S must meet (or, in the case of a denial of knowledge, fail to meet) in order for such a statement to be true. (DeRose 1999a, p. 187)

Given this, contextualists maintain that (1), (2), and (3) do not in fact conflict, even though it seems that they do. They suggest, first of all, that some contexts set very high epistemic standards, standards according to which knowledge requires a great deal. Contexts in which these high standards are in play are typically those in which we are considering and taking seriously certain skeptical hypotheses. For example, in order to know anything at all about the world around us, these high standards might require us to rule out the possibility that we are BIVs, or the possibility that we are now dreaming, or the possibility that we are now being deceived by an omnipotent but malevolent demon. Yet our perceptual experiences afford us no evidence that would allow us to rule out these skeptical possibilities, for if we were BIVs, for example, we would be having exactly the same perceptual experiences that we’re now having. Thus, we fail to meet these high epistemic standards with respect both to the belief that I have hands and to the belief that I’m not a BIV. (1) is therefore false in these high-standards contexts while (3) is true. According to contextualists, then, we should reject (1) in high-standards contexts. When we do so, we are no longer faced with a conflict, for the conflict presents itself only when we insist on the truth of each of the three mutually inconsistent claims. Moreover, in rejecting (1) in high-standards contexts, contextualism gives the skeptic his due, and takes seriously the compelling nature of skeptical arguments.

Nevertheless, contextualists maintain that in most contexts, the epistemic standards are comparatively low. Typically, these are ordinary contexts in which we are considering no skeptical hypotheses. In such contexts, we can have knowledge of the world around us without eliminating skeptical possibilities like the BIV possibility. In order to know that I have a hand, for example, I need eliminate only possibilities like those in which I have no hands, or in which I have paws or claws instead of hands. Moreover, the evidence provided by my perceptual experiences—the evidence that I obtain by looking at my hands, or by hearing the sounds made when I clap them together—does allow me to eliminate these possibilities. Thus, we can meet the epistemic standards that are in place in low-standards contexts. (1) is therefore true in these contexts while (3) is false. According to contextualists, then, we should reject (3) in low-standards contexts. And here again, in rejecting (3), we keep the conflict between (1), (2), and (3) from presenting itself. Moreover, in rejecting (3) in low-standards contexts, contextualism allows us to retain our ordinary knowledge—it allows us to know the things we ordinarily take ourselves to know.

Yet if we are never actually faced with a conflict between (1), (2), and (3), why does it seem as if we are? Contextualists respond in this way: Since we most often find ourselves in low-standards contexts, we tend to evaluate knowledge attributions according to the epistemic standards that are in place in those contexts. Thus, we tend to reckon (1) true. However, since (3) makes explicit reference to BIVs, our evaluation of that claim tends to lead us to entertain the BIV skeptical scenario. Doing this can raise the epistemic standards—it can push us into a context in which the epistemic standards are quite high—and so we tend to reckon (3) true. And so it seems that we are faced with a conflict between (1), (2), and (3). Yet it merely seems as if we are faced with such a conflict. For, as we have seen, when the epistemic standards are high, (1) is false while (3) is true. But when the standards are lower, (1) is true while (3) is false.

Contextualism also allows us to explain why it seems in certain contexts that we don’t know that we have hands (for example). We make these epistemic judgments at least partly because it’s true in such contexts that we don’t know that we have hands. And we judge in other contexts that we know that we have hands at least partly because such claims are true in those other contexts. Thus, contextualism not only helps us to see our way out of apparent conflicts like those between (1), (2), and (3), but it also helps us to explain why we make the epistemic judgments that we do.

The most prominent forms of epistemological contextualism are based either on Robert Nozick’s subjunctive conditionals account of knowledge or on the relevant alternatives theory of knowledge that is associated with Fred Dretske and Alvin Goldman. The primary difference between these two forms of contextualism is in how they characterize epistemic standards. As we will see, the former characterizes the standards in terms of subjunctive conditionals, while the latter characterizes them in terms of relevant alternatives. We will consider subjunctive conditionals contextualism in Section 2 and relevant alternatives contextualism in Sections 3 and 4. Some forms of contextualism, however, are based on neither of these theories. One such view is the version of contextualism that Stewart Cohen advocates most recently, and we will consider this view in Section 5. Let us turn now, though, to subjunctive conditionals contextualism.

2. Subjunctive Conditionals Contextualism

Keith DeRose provides an influential brand of epistemological contextualism. It is intended to solve the puzzles generated by groups of statements like the following:

1. I know that I have hands.
2. But I don’t know that I have hands if I don’t know that I’m not a BIV.
3. I don’t know that I’m not a BIV.

DeRose claims that in contexts in which the standards for knowledge are unusually high, we should reject (1) and that the skeptic can truthfully say in such contexts that I don’t know that I have hands. In other contexts, however, the epistemic standards are more relaxed and we can both reject (3) and correctly say that I do know that I have hands.

DeRose’s contextualist solution seeks to explain the plausibility of (3) by utilizing resources provided by Robert Nozick. Specifically, DeRose’s solution appeals to the Subjunctive Conditionals Account (SCA) of the plausibility of (3). According to SCA, “we have a very strong general, though not exceptionless, inclination to think that we don’t know that P when we think that our belief that P is a belief we would hold even if P were false” (DeRose 1999a, p. 193). DeRose calls the belief that P insensitive if it is one that we would hold even if P were false. SCA’s generalization thus becomes: We are inclined to think that S doesn’t know that P if we think that S’s belief that P is insensitive.

DeRose claims that even though this generalization does not represent our ordinary standard for knowledge, there are contexts in which the skeptic puts it into place as the standard (for example, by mentioning skeptical possibilities like the possibility that you are now a BIV). The standard in such contexts is the skeptical standard, according to which my beliefs must be sensitive if they are to count as knowledge. When this standard is in place, as it is in skeptical contexts, I fail to know that I’m not a BIV. For my belief that I’m not a BIV is not sensitive: I would believe that I wasn’t a BIV even if I were a BIV. Moreover, since (2) is true in all contexts, it follows that I don’t know in skeptical contexts that I have hands. In this way, DeRose’s contextualism explains the plausibility of (3) and gives the skeptic his due by arguing that there are contexts in which we should reject (1).

But DeRose wants to avoid the boldly skeptical conclusion that I never know that I have hands, and he does this by arguing that in ordinary contexts of knowledge attribution—contexts in which the skeptical standard is not in place and in which the epistemic standards are comparatively low—we can reject (3). In these contexts, the skeptical standard is not in place, and our beliefs need not be sensitive in order to count as knowledge. Thus, we can truthfully assert in ordinary contexts that I do know that I have hands. And, since (2) is true in all contexts, it follows that I know in ordinary contexts that I’m not a BIV. In this way, DeRose’s contextualism explains the plausibility of rejecting (3) and allows us to retain the knowledge that we ordinarily take ourselves to have.

According to DeRose, the relevant difference between these contexts is that the standards for knowledge are quite high in skeptical contexts but comparatively low in ordinary ones. But what accounts for this difference? DeRose recognizes that he must “explain how the standards for knowledge are raised [by the skeptic]” (DeRose 1999a, p. 206) if his solution is to be adequate. Essential to this explanation is DeRose’s Rule of Sensitivity:

When someone asserts that S knows (or does not know) that P, the standards for knowledge tend to be raised, if need be, to a level such that S’s belief that P must be sensitive if it is to count as knowledge. (DeRose 1999a, p. 206)

He then provides the following explanation of how the skeptic raises the standards.

In utilizing [puzzles like those generated by (1)-(3)] to attack our putative knowledge of O [where O is a proposition that we ordinarily take ourselves to know], the skeptic instinctively chooses her skeptical hypothesis, H, so that it will have these two features: (1) We will be in at least as strong a position to know that not-H as we’re in to know that O, but (2) Any belief we might have to the effect that not-H will be an insensitive belief…. Given feature (2), the skeptic’s assertion that we don’t know that not-H, by the Rule of Sensitivity, drives the standards for knowledge up to such a point as to make that assertion true. …And since we’re in no stronger an epistemic position with respect to O than we’re in with respect to not-H (feature (1)), then, at the high standards put in place by the skeptic’s assertion of [(3)], we also fail to know that O. (DeRose 1999a, pp. 206-7)

DeRose maintains, then, that the skeptic’s assertion is the mechanism she uses to raise the standards for knowledge. When the skeptic asserts that I don’t know that I’m not a BIV, the Rule of Sensitivity is invoked, and the standards for knowledge are raised to such a level that my beliefs must be sensitive if they are to count as knowledge. And since my belief that I’m not a BIV is not sensitive—that is, since I would believe that I wasn’t a BIV even if I were a BIV—I do not know in skeptical contexts that I’m not a BIV. Thus, given the truth of (2), I do not know in skeptical contexts that I have hands (or, for that matter, anything that I ordinarily take myself to know.)

Nevertheless, when no one mentions a skeptical hypothesis, the Rule of Sensitivity is not invoked, and the epistemic standards allow beliefs to count as knowledge even though they are not sensitive. This means that in ordinary contexts, we are still in a position to know the things we ordinarily take ourselves to know.

3. Relevant Alternatives Contextualism and Rejecting Closure

Perhaps the main motivation for epistemological contextualism is now the relevant alternatives theory of knowledge. There are two kinds of relevant alternatives contextualism. One kind rejects the closure principle, according to which knowledge is closed under known implication:

If S knows that p, and knows that p implies q, then S knows that q.

The closure principle is both plausible and explanatorily valuable. For one thing, it helps to explain how we come to know things via deduction. I know, for example, that tomorrow is Saturday. I know this because I know that today is Friday and that if today is Friday then tomorrow is Saturday. The closure principle helps to account for this knowledge, and the fact that I come to know things via deduction—and in accordance with the closure principle—renders that principle both plausible and desirable.

A second kind of relevant alternatives contextualism accepts the closure principle.

In Section 3.2, we will consider Mark Heller’s relevant alternatives contextualism, which represents accounts that reject the closure principle. Before examining Heller’s contextualism, however, we should consider the theory that motivates it.

a. Dretske’s Relevant Alternatives Theory of Knowledge

Fred Dretske proposes “to think of knowledge as an evidential state in which all relevant alternatives (to what is known) are eliminated” (Dretske 2000b, p. 52). This is the relevant alternatives theory of knowledge, or RA. But this leaves several questions unanswered.

First, what is an alternative to p? A proposition q is an alternative to p if and only if it cannot be true both that q and that p. Thus, the proposition that this animal is a Siberian grebe is an alternative to the proposition that it’s a Gadwall duck. For the animal cannot be both a Siberian grebe and a Gadwall duck.

Second, what is a relevant alternative to p? Dretske says that a relevant alternative is an alternative “that a person must be in a[n] evidential position to exclude (when he knows that P)” (Dretske 2000b, p. 57). But this doesn’t help very much at all. What is it about the alternatives that S must exclude that makes them such that she must exclude them? Unfortunately, there is no widely accepted response to this question. The vote seems to be split between two candidates. Some, including Dretske, say that an alternative q is relevant only if there is an objective possibility that q. But others say that q can be a relevant alternative simply because we regard q as a possibility.

Third, what does it mean to eliminate a relevant alternative? Here, too, there is disagreement. One view about elimination is the strongest view, according to which S can eliminate a relevant alternative q only if her evidence for believing not-q is strong enough to allow her to know that not-q. A proponent of RA might instead adopt the strong view, according to which S can eliminate q if her evidence for thinking that not-q is either strong enough to allow her to know that not-q or strong enough to allow her to have very good reason to believe that not-q. A proponent of RA might also adopt the weak view, according to which S can eliminate a relevant alternative q by meeting one of the following three conditions: (i) her evidence for not-q is strong enough to allow her to know that not-q, (ii) her evidence for not-q is strong enough to allow her to have very good reason to believe that not-q, or (iii) S’s belief that not-q is epistemically non-evidentially rational, where this is “a way in which it can be rational (or reasonable) [for S] to believe [that not-q] without possessing evidence for the belief” (Cohen 1988, p. 112). Some RA contextualists make it clear that they have something like the weak view in mind (see Cohen 1988 and Stine 1976), but most fail to make it clear which of the three views they adopt.

Dretske argues that I can know that p without eliminating the irrelevant alternatives to p. Still, he maintains that my knowing that p entails nothing whatsoever about whether I know that q, where q is an irrelevant alternative to p and might even be a necessary consequence of p. This amounts to a denial of the closure principle. Suppose that the alternative that this is a Siberian grebe is irrelevant to my knowing that it is a Gadwall duck. Notice too that the negation of the former proposition is a necessary consequence of the latter proposition—if this is a Gadwall duck, then it is not a Siberian grebe. Dretske claims that I can know that this is a Gadwall duck even though I don’t know that it’s not a Siberian grebe. Thus, Dretske holds that the closure principle is false.

This verdict is quite controversial, however, and there is disagreement over this matter even among proponents of RA. I see the lines of this disagreement as boundaries between different kinds of RA theories, and we can classify RA theories according to whether they accept or reject closure. We might choose to do this partly because RA contextualists, as well as RA theorists in general, tend to make it clear whether they accept closure, while they do not always make it clear where they stand on other issues (e.g., on the issue of relevance and on the issue of elimination). Primarily, though, we should distinguish between RA contextualists who accept closure and those who reject it because their views about closure crucially influence how they respond to skepticism. As we shall shortly see, those who reject closure deny one of the conflicting claims, namely, (2), the claim that I don’t know that I have hands if I don’t know that I’m not a BIV. So, according to RA contextualists who reject closure, there really is no conflict at all between claims (1) and (3). But according to those who accept closure, there is such a conflict. For, by the closure principle, in contexts in which I don’t know that certain skeptical alternatives do not obtain, I also fail to know certain things about the external world.

In Section 4, we will see how RA contextualists who accept closure respond to skepticism. In the following section, however, we will examine the response provided by RA contextualists who reject closure.

b. Relevant Alternatives Contextualisms that Reject Closure

Consider the puzzle that is generated by the following argument:

1. I don’t know that I’m not a BIV in a treeless world (that is, a BIVT).
2. If I know that there is a tree before me (call the italicized proposition T), and I know that T implies my not being a BIVT, then I know that I’m not a BIVT.
3. So, I don’t know that T (given that I know that T implies my not being a BIVT).

In “Relevant Alternatives and Closure,” Mark Heller follows Dretske’s lead and argues that we can solve this skeptical puzzle by rejecting the closure principle, of which (5) is an instance.

To show why we should give up (5) (and hence the closure principle), Heller argues for a particular interpretation of RA. He claims that (5) is false if his interpretation of RA is true. He calls his interpretation Expanded Relevant Alternatives, or ERA.

(ERA) S knows that p only if S does not believe p in any of the closest not-p worlds or any more distant not-p worlds that are still close enough.

ERA accounts for our inclination to think, for example, that if I know that T, I will not believe that T in any of the closest worlds in which it’s not the case that T. In addition, ERA accounts for our inclination to think that something else is sometimes needed if I am to know that T. Imagine that “the actual world is cluttered with papier mâché tree facsimiles which S is unable to distinguish from real trees” (Heller 1999b, p. 200). In this case, we are inclined to say that S doesn’t know that T even if she doesn’t believe that T in any of the closest not-T worlds. Here, even though worlds that are cluttered with papier mâché tree facsimiles are not among the closest not-T worlds, they are close enough to the actual world to count as relevant. So Heller claims that in at least some cases, if S is to know that p, she must not believe that p in any of the close enough not-p worlds.

ERA provides the foundation for a relevant alternatives contextualism, for it allows us to see different contexts as setting different epistemic standards. Which not-p worlds count as epistemically relevant—that is, which not-p worlds count as being close enough to the actual world—will vary from context to context. And since ERA characterizes epistemic standards in terms of relevant alternatives (that is, in terms of relevant not-p worlds), it allows for the context-sensitivity of epistemic standards.

In light of this, Heller maintains, we may solve the skeptical puzzle by concluding that (5) is false. Note first of all that there are no contexts in which I know that I’m not a BIVT. Given ERA, if I am to know that I’m not a BIVT, I must not believe that I’m not a BIVT in any of the closest BIVT worlds. Thus, since I do believe that I’m not a BIVT in the closest BIVT worlds, I don’t know that I’m not a BIVT.

Nevertheless, there are contexts in which I do know that T. This is true because we use “different worlds as relevant alternatives when considering whether [I know that T] from those used when considering whether [I know that I’m not a BIVT]” (Heller 1999b, p. 197). According to ERA, I know in C that T because I don’t believe that T in any of the not-T worlds that are close enough to the actual world. (And we need consider only the close enough not-T worlds because those worlds include the closest not-T worlds.) So given that ERA is true, (5) is false: I can know that there is a tree before me (and hence evade the skeptic’s snare) even though I don’t know that I’m not a BIVT. We can therefore solve the skeptical puzzle by giving up the closure principle.

Any solution to the skeptical puzzle that denies the truth of (5) must explain why it seems to us that (5) is true. In providing this explanation, Heller argues that (5) seems true because some contexts conform to the demands of the closure principle. For example, there are contexts in which astonishingly distant not-T worlds—for example, worlds in which I am a BIVT—are close enough to the actual world to count as epistemically relevant. In those contexts, I know neither that T nor that I’m not a BIVT. For, in BIVT worlds, I believe both that T and that I’m not a BIVT. The fact that there are contexts such as these, contexts that conform to the demands of the closure principle, can make it seem that (5) is true.

4. Relevant Alternatives Contextualism and Accepting Closure

Some relevant alternatives contextualisms accept the closure principle. In this section, we will examine the contextualist theory espoused by Stewart Cohen in his influential article “How to be a Fallibilist.” Cohen’s theory is perhaps the most prominent relevant alternatives contextualism and should be counted among the most notable of all contextualisms.

Cohen’s contextualism, like others, is intended to solve certain skeptical puzzles. The puzzle with which Cohen is concerned is familiar—it consists of three independently plausible but mutually inconsistent propositions.

1. I know that I have hands.
2. If I don’t know that I’m not a BIV, then I don’t know that I have hands.
3. I don’t know that I’m not a BIV.

To solve this paradox, Cohen relies on a relevant alternatives contextualism, one that accepts the plausibility—and indeed the truth—of proposition (2), which follows from the closure principle (given that I know that my having hands implies my not being a BIV). Cohen claims that in skeptical contexts, contexts in which the BIV alternative is relevant, we should accept propositions (2) and (3) but deny proposition (1). However, in ordinary contexts, contexts in which the BIV alternative is not relevant, we should accept (1) and (2) but deny (3).

Let’s look at the details of Cohen’s account. For Cohen,

an alternative (to [some proposition] q) h is relevant (for [some person] S) = df S’s epistemic position with respect to h precludes S from knowing q. (Cohen 1988, p. 101)

Cohen also claims that there are criteria of relevance and that these criteria ought to reflect our intuitions about the conditions under which S knows that q. He says that our intuitions are influenced both by conditions that are internal and by conditions that are external to a person’s evidence. Accordingly, he offers two criteria of relevance. First, there is the external criterion.

An alternative (to p) h is relevant if the probability of h conditional on reason r and certain features of the circumstances is sufficiently high (where the level of probability that is sufficient is determined by context). (Cohen 1988, p. 102)

By this criterion, the fact that there are a number of cleverly painted mules in the zoo, whether or not I have any evidence for this fact, can be sufficient to make relevant the alternative that this is a cleverly painted mule. Presumably, if there are a number of cleverly painted mules in the zoo, it is probable to some determinate degree d that this is a cleverly painted mule rather than, say, a zebra. And according to Cohen, the context determines, for example, that probabilities of degree d* and higher are sufficiently high to render an alternative relevant. Thus, according to the external criterion, if d is greater than or equal to d*, the alternative that this is a cleverly painted mule will be relevant in this context.

Second, there is the internal criterion.

An alternative (to q) h is relevant if S lacks sufficient evidence (reason) to deny h, i.e., to believe not-h (Cohen 1988, p. 103),

where the amount of evidence that is sufficient is presumably determined by context. By this criterion, the amount of evidence that S has for her belief that this is not a cleverly painted mule can be sufficiently low to make relevant the alternative that it is a cleverly painted mule. We may again presume that S has a determinate amount of evidence a for her belief that this is not a cleverly painted mule. Here, the context determines, say, that amounts of evidence a* and lower are sufficiently low to render an alternative relevant. So if a is less than or equal to a*, the alternative that this is a cleverly painted mule will be relevant in this context.

Both the internal criterion and the external criterion are sensitive to context. According to Cohen, then,

there will be no general specification of what constitutes sufficient evidence to deny an alternative in order for it not to be relevant, and as such, no general specification of what constitutes sufficient evidence to know q. Rather, this will depend on the context in which the attribution of knowledge occurs. (Cohen 1988, p. 103)

But how do the standards of relevance shift? Cohen recognizes that he must explain how this shift occurs if his contextualist solution to the skeptical paradox is to work. Because Cohen thinks of reasons as statistical in nature, he thinks that they advertise both the chance that we believe correctly on their basis and the chance that we believe erroneously on their basis. When the chances for error are highlighted, those chances become salient, and the standards for relevance shift. Thus, highlighting the chances for error allows certain alternatives to become relevant.

For example, suppose that I have reasons to believe that this is a zebra. It looks for all the world like a zebra; it is in an area of the zoo that is clearly marked “zebras”; I believe with good reason that zookeepers put only zebras in areas marked “zebras”; and so on. But perhaps someone underscores the fact that all of these reasons are compatible with this animal’s being a cleverly painted mule. Such mules look for all the world like zebras, and in a pinch even the most conscientious zookeeper might put such creatures in an area marked “zebras.” Underscoring these facts makes salient the chance that I believe erroneously on the basis of my reasons, and it makes relevant the alternative that this is a cleverly painted mule.

This suggests that, for Cohen, the standards of relevance shift whenever someone underscores the statistical nature of our reasons, whenever someone points out that there is a chance that we believe erroneously on the basis of those reasons. So, in ordinary contexts, contexts in which no one underscores the chance that I believe erroneously, that chance will not be salient, and I can know on the basis of my reasons that this is a zebra. However, in skeptical contexts, contexts in which someone does underscore the chance that I believe erroneously, that chance will be salient. In these contexts, my attention will have been focused on the chance that I am wrong, and the alternative that this is a cleverly painted mule will be relevant. Since I cannot eliminate that alternative, I do not know that this is a zebra.

Cohen suggests that his relevant alternatives contextualism allows us to solve skeptical puzzles like those that focus on zebras and cleverly painted mules. This is because his version of the relevant alternatives theory is formulated in terms of evidence, and such puzzles involve beliefs for which we can have evidence. But Cohen suggests that radical skeptical paradoxes involve beliefs for which we can have no evidence—”radical skeptical hypotheses are immune to rejection on the basis of any evidence” (Cohen 1988, p. 111). As it is, then, Cohen’s relevant alternatives contextualism seems ill equipped to resolve radical skeptical paradoxes.

To overcome this difficulty, Cohen adjusts his version of the relevant alternatives theory so that it takes into account beliefs for which I can have no evidence. He claims that for some such beliefs it is epistemically rational for me to hold them even though I possess no evidence for them. He calls beliefs of this sort intrinsically rational beliefs. Among the intrinsically rational beliefs is my belief that I’m not a BIV. According to Cohen, it is rational for me to believe that I’m not a BIV even though I have no evidence for that belief.

Taking into account intrinsically rational beliefs, Cohen amends the internal criterion of relevance. First, he says that

it is reasonable for a subject S to believe a proposition q just in case S possesses sufficient evidence in support of q, or q is intrinsically rational. (Cohen 1988, p. 113)

He then provides the following amended version of the internal criterion, or ICa:

(ICa:) An alternative (to p) h is relevant if it is not sufficiently reasonable for S to deny h (to believe not-h), where, presumably, the degree of reasonableness that is sufficient is determined by context.

Cohen now notes that according to ICa: the alternative that I am a BIV is not ordinarily relevant. For my belief that I’m not a BIV is intrinsically rational. This means that the alternative that I am a BIV does not preclude me from knowing, on the basis of my reasons, that I have hands. Thus, I can know in ordinary contexts that I have hands (given both that my reasons are sufficient for my knowing that I have hands and that all relevant alternatives are eliminated). Furthermore, Cohen claims that since the standards are comparatively low in ordinary contexts, I can also know in those contexts that I’m not a BIV.

However, there are contexts in which the skeptic underscores the fact that I can have no evidence for my belief that I’m not a BIV. By doing this, the skeptic focuses my attention on the chance of error. According to Cohen, this makes relevant the alternative that I am a BIV, and I cannot eliminate that alternative. So, by the standards that apply in these skeptical contexts, I know neither that I’m not a BIV nor that I have hands. In this way, then, Cohen solves the radical skeptical puzzle while maintaining that closure holds.

5. Contextualism and Epistemic Rationality

Certain objections have led Cohen to abandon the relevant alternatives contextualism that he presents in “How to be a Fallibilist” and to revise his contextualist solution to radical skeptical paradoxes. He is most troubled by two objections. First, he is troubled by the idea that I can have evidence for my belief that I’m not a BIV. Second, he is troubled by the idea that his account commits him to the view that I can have a priori knowledge of some contingent facts, in particular, of the fact that I’m not a BIV. On the view that he presents in “How to be a Fallibilist,” I can know that I’m not a BIV solely on the basis of the intrinsic rationality of denying that I am a BIV. According to Cohen (see Cohen 1999, p. 69), this means that I can know a priori that I’m not a BIV and hence that I can have a priori knowledge of some contingent facts. These two objections have led Cohen away from his earlier relevant alternatives contextualism.

Even though Cohen now admits that I can have evidence for my belief that I’m not a BIV, he still thinks that there are beliefs for which I can never have evidence. He formulates a new radical skeptical paradox in terms of such beliefs. Cohen asks us to imagine a creature that is a BIV but will never have evidence that it is. Call such a creature a BIV*. Now, my belief that I’m not a BIV* is a belief for which I will never have evidence. We can formulate the following new paradox in terms of that belief.

1. I know that I have hands.

1. f I don’t know that I’m not a BIV*, then I don’t know that I have hands.
2. I don’t know that I’m not a BIV*.

Since this paradox involves a skeptical hypothesis for which I can never have evidence, the idea that I can have evidence for my belief that I’m not a BIV* should not trouble Cohen’s solution to this new paradox.

But given that Cohen has abandoned the relevant alternatives framework, just what is his solution to the BIV* paradox? He notes first of all that my belief that I’m not a BIV* can be intrinsically rational, or what he now calls non-evidentially rational. Once again, S’s belief that p is non-evidentially rational if it is epistemically rational for S to believe that p even though S has no evidence for that belief. Furthermore, Cohen now suggests that

S knows that p if and only if her belief that p is epistemically rational to some degree d, where epistemic rationality has both an evidential and a non-evidential component, and where d is determined by context. (see Cohen 1999, pp. 63-69, 76-77)

Suppose, then, that I have a certain amount of evidence for my belief that I have hands, and that my belief that I have hands is therefore evidentially rational to degree de:. Suppose too that my belief that I’m not a BIV* is non-evidentially rational to some degree dne. Cohen claims that “the non-evidential rationality [of my belief that I’m not a BIV*] is a component of the overall rationality or justification for any empirical proposition” (Cohen 1999, p. 86, fn. 36). So we may suppose that my belief that I have hands is epistemically rational to degree d*, where d* equals de plus dne.

Cohen now says that the degree to which a belief must be epistemically rational if it is to count as knowledge is “determined by some complicated function of speaker intentions, listener expectations, presuppositions of the conversation, salience relations, etc.” (Cohen 1999, p. 61). He suggests that the listeners’ cooperation is an essential part of this function. He also claims that in ordinary contexts this complicated function specifies that a belief is sufficiently epistemically rational if it is epistemically rational to degree do. And d*—the degree to which my belief that I have hands is epistemically rational—is greater than do. This means that I can know in ordinary contexts that I have hands. “And since my having a hand entails my not being a brain-in-a-vat [and a fortiori a BIV*], in those same [ordinary] contexts, my belief that I am not a brain-in-a-vat is sufficiently rational for me to know I am not a brain-in-a-vat” (Cohen 1999, p. 77). This allows him to overcome the objection that I know a priori that I’m not a BIV, for “my knowledge that I am not a brain-in-a-vat is based, in part, on my empirical evidence (the evidence that I have a hand), and so is not a priori” (Cohen 1999, p. 76). In ordinary contexts, then, we accept propositions (1) and (7) of the new radical skeptical paradox, but deny proposition (8).

But in skeptical contexts the complicated function specifies that a belief is sufficiently epistemically rational only if it is epistemically rational to degree ds. And d* is less than Ds This means that in skeptical contexts “my belief that I have a hand is not sufficiently rational for me to know I have a hand. In those same [skeptical] contexts, I have no basis for knowing I am not a brain-in-a-vat” (Cohen 1999, p. 77). In skeptical contexts, we accept propositions (7) and (8) but deny proposition (1). In this way, then, Cohen solves the BIV* paradox while maintaining that closure holds.

6. Other Forms of Epistemological Contextualism

Besides those already discussed, a few other forms of epistemological contextualism warrant mention. We begin with the form that belongs to Steven Rieber, which is most similar to those already considered.

a. Explanatory Contextualism

In “Skepticism and Contrastive Explanation,” Steven Rieber provides a contextualist solution to the skeptical puzzle generated when (1), (2), and (3) are considered together. He first proposes the following analysis of knowledge:

S knows that P … iff: the fact that P explains why S believes that P. (Rieber 1998, p. 194)

He next claims that his analysis of knowledge “generates the sort of context-sensitivity needed to solve the skeptical puzzle” (Rieber 1998, p. 195). He says that “what counts as an explanation is highly context-dependent. In particular, as recent work on contrastive explanation has made clear, it can depend on an implied contrast” (Rieber 1998, p. 195). For example, only those who have syphilis contract paresis, but most of those who have syphilis never get paresis. Suppose that Smith has both syphilis and paresis. We might ask

(S) Does the fact that Smith has syphilis explain why he contracted paresis?

According to Rieber, the answer to this question can depend on what is being implicitly contrasted with Smith. If there is an implied contrast with Jones, who has neither syphilis nor paresis, then we understand (S) to be asking

(J) Does the fact that Smith has syphilis explain why he rather than Jones contracted paresis?

And the answer to (J) might well be yes. However, if there is an implied contrast with Brown, who has syphilis but did not contract paresis, then we understand (S) to be asking

(B) Does the fact that Smith has syphilis explain why he rather than Brown contracted paresis?

And the answer to (B) might well be no. So it seems that whether one thing explains another can depend on context. Thus, given Rieber’s explanatory analysis of knowledge, knowledge too will be context-sensitive.

Rieber’s analysis of knowledge seems to him to be well suited to solve the skeptical puzzle. He suggests that on his analysis of knowledge, to ask

(9) Do I know that I have hands?

is to ask

(9a) Does the fact that I have hands explain why I believe that I have hands?

Rieber claims that in ordinary contexts the answer to (9a) is clearly yes, and so I know in such contexts that I have hands. Presumably, I also know in those contexts that I’m not a BIV.

But a consideration of the BIV skeptical possibility can make salient a contrast with that possibility. When this contrast is salient, we understand (9) to be asking

(9b) Does the fact that I have hands rather than being a handless BIV explain why I believe that I have hands rather than that I am a handless BIV?

The answer to (9b) is no, for all of the evidence that I have for my belief that I have hands is compatible with my being a handless BIV. And whenever the answer to (9b) is no, so is the answer to (9). Thus, in skeptical contexts, contexts in which a contrast with the BIV possibility is salient, we should accept (3) but deny (1). The skeptic can truthfully say in such contexts that I know neither that I’m not a BIV nor that I have hands.

Rieber’s explanatory contextualism thus solves our skeptical puzzle. In ordinary contexts, we accept (1) and (2) but deny (3). I know in such contexts both that I have hands and that I’m not a BIV. However, when we consider certain skeptical possibilities, certain contrasts become salient. In these contexts, I know neither that I have hands nor that I’m not a BIV.

b. Evidential Contextualism

In “Contextualism and the Problem of the External World,” Ram Neta argues that the standards for knowledge are invariant, and therefore that we should not see the skeptic as being able to raise those standards. We ought instead to understand the skeptic to be restricting what can count as evidence. The skeptic does this, according to Neta, by exploiting the context-sensitivity of our attributions of evidence. When she brings up the BIV skeptical hypothesis, for example, the skeptic restricts what I can truthfully regard as my evidence to just those mental states that are available to me whether or not I am a BIV. That is, she prevents any of my current mental states from counting as evidence for my beliefs about the external world, thereby creating an unbridgeable (in this context, at least) epistemic gap between my evidence and my beliefs. In these contexts, my beliefs fail to meet the epistemic standard and therefore fail to count as knowledge. Still, in contexts in which I am considering no skeptical hypotheses, I can have plenty of evidence for my beliefs about the external world. In such contexts, my beliefs can meet the epistemic standards and can therefore count as knowledge. In this way, Neta’s version of contextualism, like the other versions we’ve considered, is meant to resolve familiar conflicts and to explain why we judge in most contexts that we have knowledge but why we judge in other contexts that we don’t.

c. Contextualism as a Theory of Knowledge

The last two forms of epistemological contextualism, those belonging to Michael Williams and to David Annis, have few similarities with the forms we’ve considered so far.

In his recent work, Williams argues for contextualism, which is, for him, the view that “independently of all [situational, disciplinary and other contextually variable factors], a proposition has no epistemic status whatsoever. There is no fact of the matter as to what kind of justification it either admits of or requires” (Williams 1996a, p. 119). His arguments for contextualism also count as arguments against epistemological realism, which is the view that even independently of contextual factors, there is a fact of the matter as to what kind of justification a belief requires. In particular, epistemological realism maintains the truth of the doctrine of epistemic priority (or DEP). According to DEP, our beliefs about the external world must be justified by sensory experience if they are to amount to knowledge. Williams argues that epistemological realism in general and DEP in particular are “contentious and possibly dispensable theoretical ideas about knowledge and justification” (Williams 1999b, p. 144). He also argues that skepticism depends essentially on these contentious ideas, and that, being theoretical, they are not forced on us by our ordinary ways of epistemic thinking. This suggests that skepticism is unnatural and thus that the burden of proof belongs to the skeptic. Yet since the skeptic cannot carry this burden, we have, according to Williams, no reason to take skepticism seriously.

Annis’ contextualism is meant to be an alternative both to foundationalism and to coherentism. Annis complains that both foundationalism and coherentism ignore the social nature of justification. According to his version of contextualism, then, S is justified in believing that p only if she can meet certain objections that express real doubts. These objections can include, but are not necessarily limited to, those according to which S is not in a position to know that p and those according to which p is false. We might object, for example, that since S is not reliable in situations like this, she is not in a position to know that the book on yonder shelf is brown. Thus, if S is to be justified in believing that the book is brown, she must be able to meet that objection. The justification of S’s belief that p also depends, according to Annis, on who offers certain objections and on the importance of S’s being right about p. It matters, for example, that it is S’s flight instructors, rather than her teasing friends, who object that she is unreliable when it comes to distinguishing the colors of fairly distant objects. A theory of justification that includes contextual parameters like these, Annis argues, fares better than either foundationalism or coherentism, both of which overlook the social nature of justification.

7. Objections to Contextualism

In this section, we will discuss two leading objections to epistemological contextualism. These are by no means the only criticisms that have been leveled against contextualism, but they introduce themes that have motivated additional objections as well as alternatives to contextualism. A discussion of these objections, then, should provide a center of operations for an exploration of objections to contextualism.

Palle Yourgrau (1983) argues that contextualism allows for dialogues such as the following since it claims that the standards for knowledge shift from context to context:

A: Is that a zebra?
B: Yes, it is a zebra.
A: But can you rule out its merely being a cleverly painted mule?
B: No, I can’t.
A: So you admit you didn’t know it was a zebra.
B: No, I did know then that it was a zebra. But after your question, I no longer knew.

This dialogue strikes Yourgrau as absurd, for it seems that nothing changes during the course of the conversation that would account for a change in B’s epistemic state: B is in just as good an epistemic position at the beginning of the conversation as she is at the end of the conversation, and so it seems that if B knows at the beginning, she should also know at the end. This suggests that, contrary to epistemological contextualism, we cannot affect shifts in the standards for knowledge simply by mentioning certain skeptical possibilities.

Contextualists (see DeRose 1992) have replied to this sort of objection by saying that once A introduces a skeptical possibility and thereby raises the standards for knowledge, B can no longer truly say, “I did know then that it was a zebra.” Once the standards for knowledge have been raised, the truth of any attribution of knowledge, including an attribution that is meant to apply only at some time in the past, must be judged according to those higher standards. Once the standards have been raised, B cannot both attribute knowledge to himself in the past and deny knowledge to himself in the present. He should now only deny himself knowledge; once the standards have been raised, neither B’s past self nor his present self knows that this is a zebra.

Stephen Schiffer has leveled a different sort of criticism at epistemological contextualism. Again, contextualism maintains that we attribute knowledge relative to standards that shift from context to context. This is to say, in effect, that when we say that B knows that this is a zebra, we mean that she knows relative to such-and-such an epistemic standard that this is a zebra. Putting this another way, contextualism maintains that our knowledge attributions are implicitly relative. Yet the contextualist’s response to Yourgrau’s objection suggests that B—or anyone else, for that matter—might fail to realize that our knowledge attributions are implicitly relative to an epistemic standard that shifts from context to context. Schiffer argues, however, that it is a general linguistic truth that speakers do realize that certain attributions are implicitly relative. For example, anyone who utters, “It’s raining,” in order to say that it’s raining in London knows full well that she’s asserting that it’s raining in London. Yet, according to Schiffer, when we utter, “B knows that it’s a zebra,” we typically do not take ourselves to be asserting that B knows relative to any standard. All this suggests, Schiffer argues, that the contextualist is wrong to think that our knowledge attributions are implicitly relative, and hence wrong to think that the standards for knowledge can shift from context to context.

8. Alternatives to Contextualism

Objections like these push people away from epistemological contextualism and toward theories that envisage epistemic standards that remain invariant from context to context. Two such theories present themselves as alternatives to contextualism. The first is skepticism, and the second is Mooreanism. Both skeptics and Mooreans maintain that the standards for knowledge do not shift. Yet while the skeptic claims that they are invariantly quite high, the Moorean claims that the standards are invariantly comparatively low.

The skeptic contends not only that there are no contexts in which we know that we’re not BIVs, but also that there are no contexts in which we know that we have hands (see, for example, Unger 1975 and Stone 2000). This response strikes some as implausible, however, since it does not accord with the thought that there are many contexts in which we can and do know things about the world around us.

The Moorean contends that there are never any insurmountable obstacles to our knowing both that we have hands and that we’re not BIVs.

Ernest Sosa’s Moorean response begins with the rejection of Nozick’s idea that knowledge requires sensitivity (see Section 2). He argues instead that knowledge requires safety, according to which S would believe that p only if it were the case that p (see Sosa 1999, p. 142). Moreover, both my belief that I have hands and my belief that I’m not a BIV are safe. Hence, both beliefs can always count as knowledge. Sosa says that

after all, not easily would one believe that [one was not radically deceived] without it being true … . In the actual world, and for quite a distance away from the actual world, up to quite remote possible worlds, our belief that we are not radically deceived matches the fact as to whether we are or are not radically deceived. (Sosa 1999, p. 147)

Yet if I can know across contexts that I’m not a BIV, why is it that it sometimes seems as if I don’t know that I’m not a BIV? Sosa maintains that since we can easily mistake safety for sensitivity, and since the belief that we’re not BIVs is not sensitive, it can sometimes seem to us that our belief that we’re not BIVs is not safe and thus that we don’t know that we’re not BIVs. Nevertheless, this is, according to Sosa, a mere appearance. For, since our belief is safe, we can know across contexts that we’re not BIVs and thus adopt a Moorean response to our skeptical puzzles.

Tim Black also provides a Moorean response to these puzzles. Employing Nozick’s sensitivity requirement for knowledge, Black argues in “A Moorean Response to Brain-in-a-Vat Scepticism” that the only worlds that are relevant to whether or not S knows that p are those in which S’s belief is produced by the method that actually produces it. This means that BIV worlds—possible worlds in which S is a BIV—are not relevant to whether S knows that she’s not a BIV. For BIV worlds are worlds in which her belief is produced by a method other than the one that actually produces it. Thus, since BIV worlds are not relevant to whether S know things about the external world, S can know both that she has hands and that she’s not a BIV. This, too, suggests a Moorean response to our skeptical puzzles.

9. Conclusion

We have now characterized epistemological contextualism in a way that allows several different theories to count as versions of that position. We have seen in particular that epistemological contextualists maintain that certain features of conversational contexts shape the standards that one must meet in order for one’s beliefs to count as knowledge. Understood in this way, a fairly wide range of views will count as versions of epistemological contextualism. Different versions will disagree over which features of conversational contexts can shape the epistemic standards, and over how the relevant contextual features help to shape those standards. Yet in spite of the differences between versions of epistemological contextualism, each seeks to achieve the valuable ends of explaining our epistemic judgments and solving the puzzles that are generated by skeptical arguments.

10. References and Further Reading

• Annis, David. (1978) “A Contextual Theory of Epistemic Justification.” American Philosophical Quarterly 15: 213-219.
• Austin, J. L. (1979) “Other Minds.” In Philosophical Papers, 3rd ed. New York: Oxford University Press.
• Black, Tim. (2002a) “A Moorean Response to Brain-in-a-Vat Scepticism.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 80: 148-163.
• Black, Tim. (2002b) “Relevant Alternatives and the Shifting Standards for Knowledge.” Southwest Philosophy Review 18: 23-32.
• Brueckner, Anthony. (1994) “The Shifting Content of Knowledge Attributions.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 54: 123-126.
• Cohen, Stewart. (1986) “Knowledge and Context.” Journal of Philosophy 83: 574-583.
• Cohen, Stewart. (1987) “Knowledge, Context, and Social Standards.” Synthese 73: 3-26.
• Cohen, Stewart. (1988) “How to be a Fallibilist.” Philosophical Perspectives 2, Epistemology: 91-123.
• Cohen, Stewart. (1998a) “Contextualist Solutions to Epistemological Problems: Scepticism, Gettier, and the Lottery.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 76: 289-306.
• Cohen, Stewart. (1998b) “Two Kinds of Skeptical Argument.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 58: 143-159.
• Cohen, Stewart. (1999) “Contextualism, Skepticism, and the Structure of Reasons.” Philosophical Perspectives 13, Epistemology: 57-89.
• Cohen, Stewart. (2000a) “Contextualism and Skepticism.” Philosophical Issues 10, Skepticism: 94-107.
• Cohen, Stewart. (2000b) “Replies [to Klein, Hawthorne, and Prades].” Philosophical Issues 10, Skepticism: 132-139.
• Cohen, Stewart. (2001) “Contextualism Defended: Comments on Richard Feldman’s ‘Skeptical Problems, Contextualist Solutions’.” Philosophical Studies 103: 87-98.
• DeRose, Keith. (1992) “Contextualism and Knowledge Attributions.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 52: 913-929.
• DeRose, Keith. (1996a) “Knowledge, Assertion and Lotteries.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 74: 568-580.
• DeRose, Keith. (1996b) “Relevant Alternatives and the Content of Knowledge Attributions.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 56: 193-197.
• DeRose, Keith. (1999a) “Solving the Skeptical Problem.” Reprinted in Keith DeRose and Ted A. Warfield, eds., Skepticism: A Contemporary Reader. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• DeRose, Keith. (1999b) “Contextualism: An Explanation and Defense.” In John Greco and Ernest Sosa, eds., The Blackwell Guide to Epistemology. Oxford: Blackwell.
• DeRose, Keith. (1999c) “Introduction: Responding to Skepticism.” In Keith DeRose and Ted A. Warfield, eds., Skepticism: A Contemporary Reader. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• DeRose, Keith. (2000a) “How Can We Know that We’re Not Brains In Vats?” Southern Journal of Philosophy 38 (Spindel Conference Supplement): 121-148.
• DeRose, Keith. (2000b) “Now You Know It, Now You Don’t.” Proceedings of the Twentieth World Congress of Philosophy: Volume V, Epistemology: 91-106.
• DeRose, Keith. (2002) “Assertion, Knowledge, and Context.” Philosophical Review 111 (2): 167-203.
• DeRose, Keith. (2004)a “Single Scoreboard Semantics.” Philosophical Studies 119 (1-2): 1-21.
• DeRose, Keith. (2004b) “Sosa, Safety, Sensitivity, and Skeptical Hypotheses.” In John Greco, ed., Sosa and His Critics. Oxford: Blackwell.
• Dretske, Fred I. (1981) Knowledge and the Flow of Information. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
• Dretske, Fred I. (2000a) “Epistemic Operators.” In Perception, Knowledge and Belief: Selected Essays. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Dretske, Fred I. (2000b) “The Pragmatic Dimension of Knowledge.” In Perception, Knowledge and Belief: Selected Essays. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Feldman, Richard. (1999) “Contextualism and Skepticism.” Philosophical Perspectives 13, Epistemology: 91-114.
• Feldman, Richard. (2001) “Skeptical Problems, Contextualist Solutions.” Philosophical Studies 103: 61-85.
• Fogelin, Robert J. (1999) “The Sceptic’s Burden.” International Journal of Philosophical Studies 7: 159-172.
• Garfinkel, Alan. (1981) Forms of Explanation. New Haven: Yale University Press.
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• Heller, Mark. (1999a) “The Proper Role for Contextualism in an Anti-Luck Epistemology.” Philosophical Perspectives 13, Epistemology: 115-129.
• Heller, Mark. (1999b) “Relevant Alternatives and Closure.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 77: 196-208.
• Hofweber, Thomas. (1999) “Contextualism and the Meaning-Intention Problem.” In Kepa Korta, Ernest Sosa, Xabier Arrazola, eds., Cognition, Agency and Rationality. Dordrecht: Kluwer.
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• Neta, Ram. (2003) “Contextualism and the Problem of the External World.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 66: 1-31.
• Neta, Ram. (2003) “Skepticism, Contextualism, and Semantic Self-Knowledge.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 67 (2): 396–411.
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• Pritchard, Duncan. (2001) “Contextualism, Scepticism, and the Problem of Epistemic Descent.” Dialectica 55: 327-349.
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• Rieber, Steven. (1998) “Skepticism and Contrastive Explanation.” Noûs 32: 189-204.
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• Sosa, Ernest. (2000b) “Replies [to Tomberlin, Kornblith, and Lehrer].” Philosophical Issues 10, Skepticism: 38-41.
• Sosa, Ernest. (2004) “Relevant Alternatives, Contextualism Included.” Philosophical Studies, 119 (1-2): 35-65.
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• Vogel, Jonathan. (1987) “Tracking, Closure, and Inductive Knowledge.” In Steven Luper-Foy, ed., The Possibility of Knowledge: Nozick and His Critics. Totowa, NJ: Rowman and Littlefield.
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• Vogel, Jonathan. (1997) “Skepticism and Foundationalism: A Reply to Michael Williams.” Journal of Philosophical Research 22: 11-28.
• Vogel, Jonathan. (1999) “The New Relevant Alternatives Theory.” Philosophical Perspectives 13, Epistemology: 155-180.
• Williams, Michael. (1988) “Epistemological Realism and the Basis of Scepticism.” Mind 97: 415-439.
• Williams, Michael. (1996a) Unnatural Doubts: Epistemological Realism and the Basis of Scepticism. Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
• Williams, Michael. (1996b) “Understanding Human Knowledge Philosophically.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 56: 359-378.
• Williams, Michael. (1997) “Still Unnatural: A Reply to Vogel and Rorty.” Journal of Philosophical Research 22: 29-39.
• Williams, Michael. (1999a) Groundless Belief: An Essay on the Possibility of Epistemology, 2nd ed. Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
• Williams, Michael. (1999b) “Fogelin’s Neo-Pyrrhonism.” International Journal of Philosophical Studies 7: 141-158.
• Williams, Michael. (2001) “Contextualism, Externalism and Epistemic Standards.” Philosophical Studies 103: 1-23.
• Williamson, Timothy. (2001). “Comments on Michael Williams’ ‘Contextualism, Externalism and Epistemic Standards’.” Philosophical Studies 103: 25-33.
• Yourgrau, Palle. (1983) “Knowledge and Relevant Alternatives.” Synthese 55: 175-190.

Author Information

Tim Black
Email: tim.black@csun.edu
California State University, Northridge
U. S. A.

Epistemic Closure Principles

Epistemic closure principles state that the members of an epistemic set (such as propositions known by me) bear a given relation (such as known deductive entailment) only to other members of that epistemic set.  The principle of the closure of knowledge under known logical entailment is that one knows everything that one knows to be logically entailed by something else one knows.  For instance, if I know grass is green, and I know that grass is green deductively entails that grass is green or the sky is blue, then I know that grass is green or the sky is blue.  Epistemic closure principles are employed in philosophy in myriad ways, but some theorists reject such principles, and they remain controversial.

Some people see closure principles as capturing the idea that we can add to our store of knowledge by accepting propositions entailed by what we know; others claim that this is a misunderstanding, and that closure principles are silent as to how a piece of knowledge is, or can be, acquired.  For instance, the proposition I have a driver’s license issued by the state of North Carolina entails that North Carolina is not a mere figment of my imagination.  According to the principle that knowledge is closed under known entailment, if I know the former claim, and I know the entailment, I know the latter claim.  Some insist, however, that this must be distinguished from the (possibly) false claim that I could come to know the latter on the basis of my knowing the former, since my basis for knowing the former involves presupposing the latter (by taking my sense experience and memory at more or less face value, for instance).

Closure principles are employed in both skeptical and anti-skeptical arguments.  The skeptic points out that if one knows an ordinary common sense proposition (such as that one has hands) to be true, and knows that this proposition entails the falsity of a skeptical hypothesis (such as that one is a handless brain in a vat, all of whose experiences are hallucinatory), one could know the falsity of the skeptical hypothesis, in virtue of knowledge being closed under known entailment.  Since one cannot know the falsity of the skeptical hypothesis (or so the skeptic maintains), one also must not know the truth of the common sense claim that one has hands.  Alternatively, the anti-skeptic might insist that we do know the truth of the common sense proposition, and hence, in virtue of the closure principle, we can know that the skeptical hypothesis is false.  Although the closure principle is sometimes used by anti-skeptics, some view the rejection of closure as the key to refuting the skeptic.

Table of Contents

1. The Closure of Knowledge under Known Entailment
   1. The Closure of Knowledge Under Entailment
   2. The Closure of Knowledge Under Known Entailment
   3. Justification, Single-Premise and Multiple-Premise Closure
2. Philosophical Uses of the Closure Principle
3. Externalist Accounts of Knowledge and the Rejection of Closure
   1. Epistemic Externalism and Internalism
   2. Nozick’s Tracking Account of Knowledge and the Failure of Closure
   3. Dretske’s Externalist Account of Knowledge and Closure Failure
   4. “Abominable Conjunctions”
   5. Alternative Anti-Skeptical Strategies Need Not Reject Closure
   6. Some Skeptical Arguments do not Employ Closure
4. Dogmatism and the Rejection of Closure
5. The McKinsey Paradox, Closure, and Transmission Failure
   1. The McKinsey Paradox
   2. Davies, Wright, and the Closure/Transmission Distinction
6. Ordinary Propositions, Lottery Propositions, and Closure
7. References and Further Reading
   1. References
   2. Further Reading

1. The Closure of Knowledge under Known Entailment

a. The Closure of Knowledge Under Entailment

A set is closed under a particular relation if all the members of the set bear the relation only to other members of the set. The set of true propositions is closed under entailment because true propositions entail only other truths. Since false propositions sometimes entail truths, false propositions are not closed under entailment. Epistemic closure principles state that members of an epistemic set (such as my justified beliefs) are closed under a given relation (which may be a non-epistemic relation, like entailment, or an epistemic one, such as known entailment).

A simple closure principle is the principle that knowledge is closed under entailment:

If a subject S knows that p, and p entails q, then S knows that q.

Less schematically, this says that if one knows one thing to be true and the known claim logically entails a second thing, then one knows the second thing to be true. This principle has obvious counter-examples. A complicated theorem of logic is entailed by anything (and hence by any proposition one knows), but one may not realize this and may thus fail to believe (or even grasp) the theorem. Since one must at least believe a proposition in order to know that it is true, we see that one may fail to know something entailed by something else that one knows. Additionally, even if a proposition is entailed by something one knows, if one comes to believe the proposition through some epistemically unjustified process, one will fail to know the proposition (since one’s belief of it will be unjustified). For instance, if one knows that one will start a new job today and then comes to believe that one will either start a new job today or meet a handsome stranger based on the testimony of her astrologist, then perhaps she will fail to know the truth of the entailed disjunction.

b. The Closure of Knowledge Under Known Entailment

It is more plausible that knowledge is closed under known entailment:

If S knows that p, and knows that p entails q, then S knows that q.

As stated, however, the principle seems vulnerable to counter-examples similar to the ones just discussed. The subject might fail to put his knowledge that p together with knowledge that p entails q and thus fail to infer q at all. One might know that she has ten fingers and that if she has ten fingers then the number of her fingers is not prime, but simply not bother to go on to deduce and form the belief that her number of fingers is not prime. Alternatively, although the subject could have come to believe q by inferring it correctly from something else that she knows (since she is aware of the entailment), she instead might have come to believe q through some other, epistemically unjustified, process.

How can we capture the idea that one can add to one’s store of knowledge by recognizing and assenting to what is entailed by what one already knows? This formulation seems suitably qualified:

If S knows that p, and comes to believe that q by correctly deducing it from her belief that p, then S knows that q.

Less formally, if I know one thing, correctly deduce another thing from it, and come to believe this second thing by so deducing it, then I know the second thing to be true. This principle eliminates counterexamples in which the subject fails to believe the entailed claim (and thus fails to know it) or comes to believe the entailed claim for bad reasons (and thus fails to know the claim). (Henceforth, uses in this article of the phrase “the principle of closure of knowledge under known entailment” should be regarded as referring to this preferred formulation of the principle).

So much is built into the antecedent of this principle that it might now seem trivial but, as we shall see, it has been disputed on various grounds.

c. Justification, Single-Premise and Multiple-Premise Closure

We would seem to have similar grounds for supposing that justified belief is closed under known entailment. One is epistemically justified in believing whatever one correctly deduces from one’s justified beliefs. This captures the idea that one way to add to one’s store of justified beliefs is to believe things entailed by your justified beliefs. When one reasons validly, the justification that one has for the premises carries over to the conclusion.

The mere fact that justification is (ordinarily taken to be) one of the necessary conditions for knowledge does not strictly entail that justification is closed under the same operations (such as known entailment) that knowledge is closed under. As Steven Hales (1995) has pointed out, to argue in this manner is to commit the fallacy of division: to infer from the fact that a whole thing has a particular quality, that each of its components must have this quality as well. For instance, it does not follow from the fact that the glee club is loud that each, or even any, of the individual singers in the glee club is loud. Knowledge might be closed under known entailment even if justified belief is not, if all the counterexamples to the closure of justification were examples in which the justified belief was missing at least one of the necessary conditions for knowledge. There seems to be no particular reason to believe that this is the case, however. (See Brueckner 2004 for more on this point).

The closure principles discussed thus far are instances of single premise closure. For instance, one’s knowledge that a given particular premise is true, when combined with a correct deduction from that premise of a conclusion, seems to guarantee that one knows the conclusion. There are also multiple premise closure principles. Here is an example:

If S knows that p and knows that q, and S comes to believe r by correctly deducing it from p and q, then S knows that r.

That is, if I know two things to be true and can deduce a third thing from the first two, then I know the third thing to be true. There is good reason to be dubious of multiple premise closure principles of justification, such as

If S is justified in believing that p and justified in believing that q, and S correctly deduces r from p and q, then S is justified in believing that r.

Lottery examples reveal the difficulty. Given that there are a million lottery tickets and that exactly one of them must win, it is plausible (though not obvious) that for any particular lottery ticket, I am justified in believing that it will lose. So I am justified in believing that ticket one will lose, that ticket two will lose, and so forth, for every ticket. But if I know that there are a million tickets, and I am justified in believing each of a million claims to the effect that ticket n will lose and I can correctly deduce from these claims that no ticket will win, then by closure I would be justified in concluding that no ticket will win, which by hypothesis is false. Justified belief is fallible, in that one can be justified in believing something even if there is a chance that one is mistaken; conjoin enough of the right sort of justified but fallible beliefs and the resulting conjunction will be unlikely to be true, and thus unjustified.

If knowledge, like justified belief, is fallible (say, only 99.9% certainty is required), then multiple premise closure principles for knowledge will fail as well. One could be sufficiently certain for knowledge about each of a thousand claims (“I will not die today”; “I will not die tomorrow”; …; “I will not die exactly 569 days from today”; etc.), but not sufficiently certain of the conjunction of these claims (“I will not die on any of the next thousand days”) in order to know it, even though it is jointly entailed by those thousand known claims (and thus true). The fallibility of knowledge is far more controversial than the fallibility of justified belief, however.

Similarly, closure might be thought to hold for different types of knowledge, such as a priori knowledge (i.e. knowledge not gotten through sense experience, to oversimplify a bit). If one knows a priori that p, and knows a priori that p entails q, then one knows a priori that q. Intuitively, it seems that if one knows the premises of an argument a priori and is able to validly deduce a conclusion from those premises, one would know the conclusion a priori as well. This last point is on weaker ground, however, as discussed in Section 5b.

2. Philosophical Uses of the Closure Principle

The closure principle, now qualified to handle the straightforward counterexamples, has been employed in skeptical and anti-skeptical arguments, in support of a dogmatic refusal pay attention to evidence that counts against what one knows, to generate a paradox about self-knowledge, and for many other philosophical ends.  These uses are described in brief in this section, and in greater detail in later sections.

The skeptic may argue as follows:

1. I do not know that I am not a handless, artificially stimulated brain in a vat.
2. I do know that I have hands entails I am not a handless, artificially stimulated, brain in a vat.
3. If I know one thing, and I know that it entails a second thing, then I also know the second thing. (Closure)
4. Thus, I do not know that I have hands. (From 2 and 3, if I knew I had hands I would know that I am not a brain in a vat, in contradiction with 1).

If one really knew the ordinary common sense claim to be true, one could deduce the falsity of the skeptical claim from it and come to know that the skeptical claim is false (by closure). The fact that one cannot know that the skeptical claim is false (as per the first premise) demonstrates that one does not in fact know that the common sense proposition is true either. (See also Contemporary Skepticism).

But one person’s modus tollens (the inference from if p then q and not-q to the conclusion not-p) is another person’s modus ponens (the inference from if p then q and p to the conclusion q), as we can see from an anti-skeptical argument of the sort associated with G.E. Moore. (See Moore 1959).

1. I know that I have hands.
2. I know that I have hands entails I am not a handless, artificially stimulated, brain in a vat.
3. If I know one thing, and I know that it entails a second thing, then I also know the second thing. (Closure)
4. Thus, I know that I am not a handless, artificially stimulated brain in a vat.

From the fact that one knows that she has hands and this is incompatible with a skeptical hypothesis under which her hands are illusory, one can infer, and thus come to know (if closure is correct), the falsity of the skeptical hypothesis.

The closure principle can be used even in defense of a dogmatic rejection of any recalcitrant evidence that counts against something that one takes oneself to know. The argument runs as follows (adapted from Harman 1973):

1. I know my car is parked in Lot A. (Assume)
2. I know that if my car is parked in Lot A, and there is evidence that my car is not parked in Lot A (say, testimony that the car has been towed), then the evidence is misleading. (Analytic, since evidence against a truth must be misleading)
3. Thus, I know that any evidence that my car is not parked in Lot A is misleading. (Closure)
4. I know that there is evidence that my car is not parked in Lot A. (Assume)
5. Thus, I know that this evidence (testimony that my car was towed) is misleading. (Closure)
6. If a piece of evidence is known by me to be misleading, then I ought to disregard it. (Analytic)
7. Thus, I ought to disregard any evidence that my car is not parked in Lot A. (From 5 and 6)

This result seems paradoxical, however, as most would claim that it is epistemically irresponsible to ignore all the evidence against what one takes oneself to know, simply because it is evidence against what one takes oneself to know. It is plausible (though hardly obvious) that one takes oneself to know each thing that one believes (considered individually). If this is conjoined with the argument above, it entails that one ought to ignore any evidence against what one believes. This seems to be an even more ill-considered policy.

The closure principle also figures prominently in a paradox about self-knowledge and knowledge of the external world. It is now widely accepted that some thought contents are individuated externally. That is, there are some thought contents that one could not have unless one was in an environment or linguistic community that is a certain way. On this view, one could not think the thought that water is wet were one not in an environment with water, or at least with some causal connection to water. Given content externalism, it seems we may argue as follows (the argument is due to McKinsey 1991):

1. I know that I have mental property M (say, the thought that water is wet). (Assume privileged access to one’s own thoughts)
2. I know that if I have mental property M (the thought that water is wet), then I meet external conditions E (say, living in an environment containing water). (Externalism with respect to content)
3. If I know one thing, and I know that it entails a second thing, then I know the second thing. (The principle of the closure of knowledge under known entailment).
4. Thus, I know that I meet external conditions E (namely, that I live in environs containing water). (From 1, 2 and 3)

The conclusion follows from an application of the closure principle, but what makes this paradoxical is that it appears that the knowledge that is attributed in the premises depends on reflection alone (introspection plus a priori reasoning), whereas the knowledge attributed in the conclusion is empirical. If the premises are correct, and closure holds, I can know an empirical fact by reflection alone (since I know it on the basis of premises than can be known by reflection alone). Something seems to have gone wrong and it is unclear which premise, if any, is the culprit.

Closure principles figure in another philosophical puzzle about knowledge of “ordinary propositions”, those we ordinarily take ourselves to know, and “lottery propositions,” those that, although extremely likely, we do not ordinarily take ourselves to know. Suppose that one is struggling to get by on a pensioner’s income. It seems plausible to say that one knows one will not be able to afford a mansion on the French Riviera this year. However, that one will not be able to afford the mansion this year entails that one will not win the lottery. By the closure principle, since one knows that one will not be able to afford the mansion, and knows that this entails that one will not win the lottery, one must know that one will not win the lottery. However, very few are inclined at accept that one knows one will not win the lottery. After all, there’s a chance one could win.

3. Externalist Accounts of Knowledge and the Rejection of Closure

a. Epistemic Externalism and Internalism

To determine whether someone is epistemically justified in believing something, one must do so from a particular point of view. One may consider the point of the view of the agent who holds the belief or of someone who possesses all the relevant information (which may be unavailable to the agent). To oversimplify, those who consider only the subject’s perspective when evaluating the subject’s epistemic justification are epistemic internalists, and those who adopt the point of view of one with all the relevant information are epistemic externalists. An account of epistemic justification is internalist if it requires that all the elements necessary for an agent’s belief to be epistemically justified are cognitively accessible to the agent; that is, these elements (say, evidence or reasons) must be internal to the agent’s perspective. Externalist theories of justification, on the other hand, allow that some of the elements necessary for epistemic justification (such as a belief’s being produced by a process that makes it objectively likely to be true) may be cognitively inaccessible to the agent and external to the agent’s perspective.

There are so many varieties of internalism and externalism that further generalization is perilous. Considering the theories’ respective treatments of the problem of induction illustrates the basic difference between them. Hume famously argued that although we rely on inductive inferences, we have access to no non-question begging justification for doing so, as our only grounds for thinking that induction will continue to be reliable is that it always has been reliable. This is an inductive justification of the belief that induction is epistemically justified. If Hume is right, then a typical internalist will concede that beliefs based on inductive reasoning are not epistemically justified. An externalist, however, might insist that such beliefs are justified, provided that inductive reasoning as a matter of fact is a process that reliably produces mostly true beliefs, whether the agent who reasons inductively has access to that fact or not. On the other hand, an epistemic internalist might rate the beliefs of a brain in a vat or a victim of Cartesian evil demon deception as epistemically justified, provided that they were formed in a way that seems reasonable from the point of the view of the agent (the brain in a vat), such as through the careful consideration of evidence (evidence, albeit, that is misleading). The epistemic externalist, however, likely would rate such an agent’s beliefs as unjustified, on the basis of evidence not accessible to the agent, such as that the belief-forming processes she relies on make her beliefs extremely likely to be false.

For the most part, internalist accounts of knowledge are those that appeal to an internalist conception of epistemic justification and externalist accounts of knowledge employ an externalist conception of justification. (Alternatively, one may be an internalist about justification and an externalist about knowledge, by rejecting the view that epistemic justification is one of the requirements for knowledge.) Perhaps the greatest challenge to closure principles for knowledge comes from externalist theories of knowledge, notably those of Robert Nozick and Fred Dretske.

b. Nozick’s Tracking Account of Knowledge and the Failure of Closure

It strikes many that some version of the closure principle must be true. The idea that no version of the principle is true is, according to one noted epistemologist, “one of the least plausible ideas to come down the philosophical pike in recent years.” (Feldman 1995) Nevertheless, philosophers have argued against the epistemic closure principle on many different grounds. One serious challenge to closure arose from those who proposed the “tracking” analysis of knowledge (notably Nozick 1981). According to the tracking theory, to know that p is to track the truth of p. That is, one’s true belief that p is knowledge if and only if the following two conditions hold: if p were not the case, one would not believe that p, and if p were the case, one would believe that p. For one’s belief that p to be knowledge, one’s belief must be sensitive to the truth or falsity of p; that sensitivity is captured by the two subjunctive conditions above. One knows that Albany is the capital of New York only if one would not believe it if it were false, and would believe it if it were true. (See also Robert Nozick’s epistemology).

This is an externalist theory of knowledge because whether or not an agent satisfies the subjunctive conditions for knowledge may not be cognitively accessible to the agent. To evaluate an agent’s belief, with respect to whether it meets those conditions, it may be necessary to adopt the point of view of someone with information not accessible to the agent.

Let’s illustrate this with an example similar to Nozick’s own (1981, 207). Let p be the belief that one is sitting in a chair in Jerusalem. Let q be the belief that one’s brain is not floating in a tank on Alpha Centauri, being artificially stimulated so as to make one believe one is sitting in a chair in Jerusalem. Suppose one has a true belief that p. In the “closest” counterfactual situations (to employ the terminology of one account of truth-conditions for subjunctives) in which p is false (say, one is standing in Jerusalem, or one is sitting in Tel Aviv), one will not believe p. In close counterfactual situations in which one is sitting in Jerusalem, one does believe that p. One’s belief of p tracks the truth of p and thus counts as knowledge.

Suppose, on the other hand, that one has a true belief that q. If one’s belief that q were false, however (and one really was in this predicament on Alpha Centauri), one would still believe (falsely) that one was not in Alpha Centauri (q). One’s belief that q, while actually true, does not track the truth of q (being held when q is true but not when q is false). Hence, the belief that q does not count as knowledge.

How does this relate to the closure of knowledge? The proposition that one is sitting in Jerusalem (p) entails that one’s brain is not floating in a tank in Alpha Centauri, being stimulated so as to make one think that one is sitting in Jerusalem (q). We may suppose that one can correctly deduce q from p. Even so, since one’s belief that p tracks the truth of p and counts as knowledge and one’s belief that q does not do so, knowledge fails to be closed under known entailment. One may know that p, and know that p entails q (and come to believe the latter by correctly deducing it from the former), and yet fail to know that q.

Nozick’s account has at least two virtues. One is that the tracking analysis of knowledge is plausible. The other is that the rejection of closure allows us to reconcile the following two claims, both of which seem plausible but had seemed incompatible: (1) we do know many common sense propositions, such as that I have hands, and (2) we do not know that skeptical hypotheses, such as that I am a handless, artificially stimulated brain in a vat, are false. One desideratum of a theory of knowledge is that it refutes skepticism while accounting for the plausibility and persuasiveness of the skeptic’s case against common sense knowledge claims. Both the skeptic and the Moorean anti-skeptic come up short here. The skeptic must deny our common sense knowledge claims and the Moorean must maintain that we can know the falsity of skeptical hypotheses. As long as we accept the closure principle, whether we are skeptics or anti-skeptics, we cannot maintain both that we know common sense propositions and that we do not know that the skeptical hypotheses are false, since we know that the common sense propositions entail the falsity of the skeptical propositions. Knowledge of the truth of the common sense claims would, if knowledge is closed under known entailment, guarantee our knowledge that skeptical hypotheses are false. Citing our failure to know that skeptical hypotheses are false, the skeptic applies modus tollens and infers that we must not know the common sense propositions. The rejection of closure blocks this move by the skeptic.

This is not to say that there are not plausible counterexamples to the tracking account of knowledge. I may know my mother is not the assassin since she was with me when the assassination took place. But counterfactually, if she were the assassin, I would still believe she was not, since after all I couldn’t believe such a thing of my mother. My belief that my mother is not the assassin fails to track the truth, since I would have believed it even if it were false, but it seems quite plausible that I do know she’s not the assassin, as my evidence for her innocence is quite overwhelming – my mother cannot be in two places at once. Tracking accounts like Nozick’s, which do not make reference to the reasons the agent has for the belief in question, seem vulnerable to such counterexamples.

c. Dretske’s Externalist Account of Knowledge and Closure Failure

Dretske’s account of knowledge is as follows: one’s true belief that p on the basis of reason R is knowledge that p if only if (i) one’s belief that p is based on R and (ii) R would not hold if p were false. Less formally, we may put this as follows: one knows a given claim to be true only if one has a reason to believe that it is true, and one would not have this reason to believe it if it were not true. (See Dretske 1971). This is an externalist account because whether an agent meets conditions (i) and (ii) above may be inaccessible to the agent. One could believe a claim on the basis of a particular reason without being able to explain one’s reliance on that reason, and without knowing whether one would still have the reason if the claim were false. For instance, one might believe that one’s toes are curled on the basis of proprioceptive evidence (evidence that one would not have if one’s toes were not curled), without one having any idea what proprioception is, what sort of evidence one has for the claim that one’s toes are curled, or whether one would have such evidence even if one’s toes were uncurled.

Let’s illustrate Dretske’s account with his famous zebra example (Dretske 1970). Suppose one is in front of the zebra display at the zoo. One believes that one is seeing zebras on the basis of perceptual evidence. Furthermore, in the closest possible worlds in which one is not seeing zebras (where the display is of camels or tigers), one would not have that perceptual evidence. Consequently, one knows that one is now seeing zebras, on the basis of the perceptual evidence one is having. Consider, however, the belief that one is not now seeing mules cleverly disguised by zoo staff to resemble zebras. Whatever one’s reason for believing this claim (say, that it is just very unlikely that the zoo would deceive people in that fashion), one would still have this reason even if the belief were false (and one was seeing mules cleverly disguised to look like zebras). Hence, one would not know that one is not now seeing mules cleverly disguised to resemble zebras.

As with Nozick’s account, this provides a counterexample to the closure of knowledge. One can know that one is now seeing zebras, one can correctly deduce from this that one is not now seeing mules cleverly disguised to resemble zebras, and yet fail to know that one is not now seeing mules cleverly disguised to resemble zebras. Furthermore, Dretske’s account better handles the counterexample to Nozick’s theory. One believes (truly) that one’s mother is not the assassin, on the grounds that one was with one’s mother at the time the assassination happened (and that mother cannot be in two places at once) and one would not have this reason to think mother innocent if she were indeed the assassin. Thus, one knows that one’s mother is not the assassin, since the evidence is absolutely conclusive, despite the fact that if one’s mother were the assassin, one would still believe that she wasn’t, on the basis of a different, bad reason.

Even Dretske’s account is plausibly vulnerable to counterexample. Suppose that one believes correctly at noon on Tuesday that Jones is chair of one’s department, on the basis of the typical sort of evidence (say, recollection of Jones being installed in the position, the department’s website listing Jones as chair, and so forth). Suppose that at five minutes past noon on Tuesday, Jones is suddenly struck dead by a bolt of lightning (and is consequently no longer chair). Did one know at noon, five minutes prior to the death, that Jones was the chair? Since one would have had that same set of reasons to believe at noon that Jones was chair even in the closest possible worlds in which he was not chair at noon (that is, worlds in which he’d been struck dead by lightning five minutes before noon), one does not actually know at noon that Jones is the chair. Those who find this verdict implausible (that is, those who think one does know on the basis of the typical evidence that Jones is the chair, right up until the moment that Jones suddenly is struck dead and stops being the chair), may find Dretske’s account of knowledge wanting. (The example is adapted from Brueckner and Fiocco 2002).

Further justification of Dretske’s for denying closure is that there are other sentential operators that are not closed under known entailment and behave in many respects like the knowledge operator. (See Dretske 1970). Dretske defines a sentential operator O to be fully penetrating when O(p) is closed under known entailment. That is, O is penetrating if and only if: O(p) entails O(q) if p is known to entail q. “It is true that” is a penetrating operator, since, if p is known to entail q, “it is true that p” must entail “it is true that q”. “It is surprising that” is non-penetrating; although it is surprising that tomatoes are growing on the apple tree, it is not surprising that something is growing on the apple tree. Some operators are semi-penetrating. An operator is semi-penetrating when it penetrates only to a certain subset of a given proposition’s entailments.

For instance, “R is an explanatory reason for” seems to be a semi-penetrating operator. Within a range of cases, if p is known to entail q, then R is an explanatory reason for p entails R is an explanatory reason for q. A reason that explains why Bill and Harold are invited to every party necessarily is a reason why Harold is invited to every party. Similarly, “knows that” seems to penetrate through similar entailments; if one knows that Bill and Harold are invited to every party, then one knows that Harold is invited to every party.

However, “R is an explanatory reason for my painting the walls green” need not entail “R is an explanatory reason for my painting the walls.” Depending on the context, a reason that explains why I painted my walls green may be a reason why I did something entailed by my painting the walls green, such as my not painting the walls red, but may not be a reason why I did something else entailed by my painting the walls green, such as my not wallpapering the walls green. The emphasis is crucial. A reason to paint the walls green is a reason not to paint them red, but may not be a reason to paint rather than wallpaper. A reason to paint the walls green may be a reason not to paint the floor green, but it might be neutral as to the color. Consideration of ordinary demands for reasons shows that emphasis, or other contextual factors, determines a certain range of reasons to be relevant and a certain range irrelevant. The same reason will not suffice to explain each of the following: “I bought tomatoes,” “I bought tomatoes” and “I bought tomatoes”, even though these three sentences entail and are entailed by exactly the same claims, since they are logically equivalent. Dretske says that no fact is an island and that various contextual factors will determine, for each operator, its relevant alternatives (i.e. the negations of the consequents to which the operator penetrates). (See also Contextualism in Epistemology, Chapter 3, on Dretske and the denial of closure).

d. “Abominable Conjunctions”

On the other hand, some philosophers view the closure principle as so obviously true that, rather than reject it to accommodate a given theory of knowledge, they would reject the account of knowledge in order to keep closure. Dretske’s account of knowledge has been much discussed in the philosophical literature. One consequence of this rejection of closure in favor of his account that hardly seems felicitous is that one could truly say, “I know that that animal is a zebra and I know that zebras are not mules, but I don’t know that that animal is not a cleverly disguised mule.” Or, “I know I have hands, and I know that if I have hands I am not handless, but I don’t know that I am not a handless brain in a vat.” Worse yet, “I know it is not a mule, but I don’t know it’s not a cleverly disguised mule.” These claims (“abominable conjunctions,” according to DeRose 1995) sound at best paradoxical and at worst absurd. This seems to point to the extreme plausibility of some form or another of the closure principle.

Dretske (2005a, 17-18) agrees that such statements sound absurd, but maintains that they are true. They may violate conventional conversational expectations and they may be met with incomprehension, but they are not self-contradictory. “Empty” and “flat” are often taken to be absolute concepts (since to be empty is to not contain anything at all and to be flat is to have no bumps), but also context-relative, in that whether a particular item counts as a thing or a bump depends on the context. It sounds a bit strange to say that the warehouse is empty, but has lots of dust, gas molecules, and empty crates in it. The utterance may violate conversational rules, but the utterance might, despite all that, be true, if the concepts of emptiness and flatness are as described. So too with the abominable conjunctions if the attendant conception of knowledge is correct. Philosophers may always appeal to Gricean conversational implicatures to blunt the objection that their view entails absurd claims. Truth and conversational propriety are not one and the same. (Paul Grice is the philosopher most closely associated with the view that communication is guided by various conversational maxims and that some utterances are conversationally inappropriate, even if true, because they invite misunderstanding. For instance, the utterance “Mary insulted her boss and she was fired,” is true even if Mary did not insult her boss until after she was fired, but it would be an inappropriate remark in most contexts, since the listener naturally would conclude that the insult preceded the dismissal. For more on this, see Grice 1989).

John Hawthorne (2005: 30-31) makes two points in reply. First, he says, it is unclear what sort of Gricean mechanism could make it true but conversationally inappropriate to utter “S knew that p and correctly deduced q from p, but did not know that q.” Second, an appeal of this sort can at best explain why we do not utter certain true propositions, but not why we actually believe their negations. Even if it is true that one’s wife is his best friend, it would be inappropriate for him to introduce her to someone as his best friend. But the conversational mechanism at play here could hardly be an explanation for why he believed that his wife was not his best friend (even though she was). Why, if the denial of closure is true but conversationally infelicitous, do so many not only not deny closure in conversations but in fact believe that the closure principle is true?

One might reply that many people, even philosophers, are apt in some situations to mistake what is conversationally appropriate for what is true (as with conditional claims that have false antecedents), so an explanation of why a true claim violates conversational norms might well explain why people believe the negation of the claim.

e. Alternative Anti-Skeptical Strategies Need Not Reject Closure

There are alternative strategies for refuting skepticism that seem to have many of the virtues of the tracking account of knowledge, but do not entail the falsity of closure principles. Contextualism, for example, says that knowledge attributions are sensitive to context, in that a subject S might know a proposition p relative to one context, but simultaneously fail to know that p relative to another context. The contextual factors to which knowledge attributions are taken to be sensitive include things like whether a particular doubt has been raised or acknowledged and the importance of the belief being correct.

In an ordinary context, where skeptical scenarios have not been raised, the standards for knowledge are quite low, but, in contexts in which skeptical doubts have been raised, such as an epistemology class, standards for knowledge have been raised to levels that typically cannot be met. One might know relative to the everyday context that she has hands, but fail to know this relative to the skeptic’s context, because a skeptical scenario has been raised and she cannot rule it out.

Or a true belief with a certain level of justification might count as knowledge as long as it is not terribly important that the belief be correct, but would no longer be knowledge if the stakes were raised. One might know that the bank will be open on Saturday after confirming that the bank has Saturday hours, even if one has not checked whether the bank has changed its hours in the past two weeks, as long as no great harm will befall one if it turns out one is wrong. But if financial ruin will befall one were a check not deposited before Monday, then one’s justification might need to be stronger before it would be correct to say that one knows the bank is open Saturday.

The contextualist then can reconcile the intuitions that it is sometimes correct to attribute to someone knowledge of everyday common sense propositions, despite her inability to rule out skeptical propositions, and that we are sometimes correct in refusing to attribute knowledge of the falsity of a skeptical scenario when the subject is unable to rule out such scenarios. But the contextualist can do this while accepting at least some version of closure. The contextualist says that epistemic closure holds within an epistemic context, but fails inter-contextually. For instance, in the everyday, low epistemic standards context, one knows that one has hands and anything that one can correctly deduce from this claim, such as that one is not a handless being deceived into thinking that one has hands. In the context with much higher epistemic standards, one knows neither that one is not a handless, artificially stimulated brain in a vat, nor (by an application of the closure of knowledge under known entailment) that one has hands. Closure will fail only when it extends across contexts. For instance, if one were to cite one’s knowledge that one has hands (in the ordinary context) as grounds for saying in the heightened context that one knows that the brain in a vat hypothesis is false (as the Moorean might), one would illegitimately apply the closure principle. The skeptic’s citing one’s failure to know the falsity of the skeptical hypothesis (in the heightened context) as entailing that one does not know the common sense proposition (in the ordinary context) would be a similar misuse of the closure principle.

If a theory of knowledge is independently plausible and can answer the skeptic without denying closure, then, everything else being equal, we ought to be reluctant to reject closure just so that we can accept the tracking account of knowledge. Contextualism, of course, is plagued with problems of its own. One such problem is as follows: since whether one knows a claim or not depends on how stringent the epistemic standards are in the context and the standards can be raised by a particular doubt occurring to someone in the context, contextualism seems to imply that it is easier to know things if one spends time with the stupid or incurious or if one is stupid or incurious.

The plausibility of the denial of closure may well depend not only on whether it is a way to avoid skepticism, but on whether it is the only way to do so. (Dretske does insist that the only plausible way to refute skepticism is by denying closure. See his 2005a and 2005b for a defense of this claim, trenchant criticisms of the contextualist theory, and responses to criticisms of the tracking theory.)

f. Some Skeptical Arguments do not Employ Closure

One of the strengths claimed for the tracking account of knowledge is that it blocks the standard skeptical argument, since it involves the rejection of closure. Not all skeptical arguments employ closure principles, however, so it is unclear how much anti-skeptical value would accrue from denying closure. Underdetermination arguments might be the best skeptical arguments and they do not depend (at least explicitly) on closure.

Underdetermination is a relation that holds between two or more theories, when the theories are incompatible, but empirically equivalent. Underdetermination skeptical arguments rely crucially on the premise that if two theories are incompatible but compatible with all the available (and perhaps possible) data, we cannot know that one is true and the other false. Compare, for example, the thesis that I have hands, which I perceive through sense perception, and the thesis that I am a handless brain in a vat, artificially stimulated so as to have misleading sense perceptions. These theses are incompatible, but they are empirically equivalent. Whichever thesis were true, I would have the same sort of experiences. Suppose we adopt the following principle: if two incompatible theses both entail (or predict) the same observational data, then that observational data does not support (or justify belief of) one of the theses over the other. With this principle and the premise that the two theses are incompatible but observationally equivalent, we can deduce that our apparent perception of our hands does not justify us in believing that we have hands.

The argument is greatly oversimplified, but the outline of the skeptical argument from underdetermination now ought to be clear. The argument does not explicitly employ any closure premise, so the rejection of closure would seem not to undermine the argument in any straightforward way. One could always argue that the appeal of the argument from underdetermination implicitly relies on the closure principle or that the argument from underdetermination is objectionable on other grounds. Skeptical arguments from underdetermination, however, seem as plausible as other skeptical arguments and their plausibility seems not to depend on the plausibility of any of the closure principles.

Infinite regress arguments for skepticism also do not straightforwardly appeal to closure. A regress argument that no belief is epistemically justified (and hence than no belief counts as knowledge) runs as follows. We assume that all justification is inferential. That is, every justified belief is justified by appeal to some other justified belief. The basis for this claim might be the nature of argumentation. One is justified in believing a conclusion if one is justified in believing the premises that support the conclusion. If the conclusion is one of the premises, then the argument is question-begging, or circular, and not rationally persuasive. But if every justified belief can be justified only be inferring it from some further justified belief and there cannot be an infinite regress of justified beliefs, then it must be that no beliefs are justified. (A foundationalist about justification, on the other hand, while agreeing that an infinite regress of justified beliefs is impossible, insists that there are justified beliefs, and hence that some beliefs are justified non-inferentially, or in other words, that some justified beliefs are basic or foundational). The claim that no justified belief is self-justifying does not entail any closure principle of justification or knowledge, so the argument seems to be independent of closure and thus not vulnerable to arguments against closure principles. (See also Ancient Skepticism).

The proponent of the tracking account of knowledge need not answer all forms of the skeptical argument with the same tools, so even if some skeptical arguments do not depend on the closure principle, the tracking analysis might provide the resources for countering the skeptical arguments from underdetermination or regress.

4. Dogmatism and the Rejection of Closure

At least one philosopher (Audi 1988, 76-8; 1991, 77-84) has claimed that the justification of dogmatism, adapted from Harman (see section 2 of this article), is a reductio ad absurdum of the epistemic closure principle. If closure allows one to infer, and thus know, that any evidence against something one knows must be misleading and may be ignored, then closure must be rejected.

Audi’s example is of a man who adds up a series of numbers and thereby knows the sum of the numbers. But the man’s wife (whom he considers to be a better mathematician) says that he has added the numbers incorrectly and gotten the wrong sum. If the man knows that the sum is n, and knows that his wife says the sum is not n, then by closure he knows that his wife is wrong. (This is so, as “the sum is n and my wife says the sum in not n” entails that “my wife is wrong;” one knows the former claim and knows it entails the latter, so one knows the latter). Since he knows his wife is wrong, there is no need to recalculate the sum. (Similar examples appear in Dretske 1970 and Thalberg 1974). If one believes something only when one takes oneself to know it, as is plausible, then by this reasoning one has reason to dismiss any evidence against something that one believes.

Denying the closure principle to avoid the odd dogmatic conclusion has some initial appeal, but there are alternative solutions that do not require us to reject such a compelling principle. And, as Feldman says (1995, 493), there is a general reason not to resolve the paradox by denying closure. To say, “Yes, I know that p is true, and that p entails q, but I draw the line at q,” seems irrational. To refuse to accept what you know to be the consequences of your beliefs, he says, is to be “patently unreasonable.” Not only is it infelicitous to deny closure, but the dogmatist argument may be blocked without doing so.

For instance, one could take the dogmatism argument to be a reductio ad absurdum of the anti-skeptical position. This is the tack taken by Peter Unger (1975). If we deny that one could know that p (say, that the sum of the numbers is n), then even if we accept closure, we have no reason to suppose that one could know that all evidence against p was misleading.

Alternatively, Roy Sorensen (Sorensen 1988) argues that given that one knows that p, the conditional “If E is evidence against p, then E is misleading” is a junk conditional, in that although it may be known to be true, this knowledge cannot be expanded under modus ponens. That is to say, if “if p then q” is a junk conditional, the conditional can be known to be true, but it could not be the case that simultaneously the conditional is known and that knowledge of the antecedent p would justify one in believing the consequent q. Some conditionals are known to be true on the basis of the extreme unlikelihood of the antecedent, but are such that if one acquired evidence that supports the antecedent, one would not be justified in inferring the consequent because the probability of the antecedent is inversely proportional to the probability of the conditional. That is, if one were to learn that the antecedent of the conditional was true, one would no longer have reason to accept (and would no longer know) the conditional. “If this is a Cuban cigar, then I’m a monkey’s uncle!” is an example of such a conditional. This conditional can be known to be true, in virtue of the antecedent being known to be false, but if one were to find evidence that this is indeed a Cuban cigar, one should not infer that he is a monkey’s uncle. Rather, one should conclude that perhaps one did not know the conditional to be true after all, since one has evidence that its antecedent was true and its consequent false. In short, if a conditional is a junk conditional one cannot come to know the consequent q in virtue of one’s knowing the antecedent p and the conditional if p then q, because one’s knowledge of the conditional depends on the falsity of the antecedent.

Given that one knows that r (say, that one’s car is in parking lot A), one knows that the conditional “if there is any evidence against r, however strong, then it must be misleading” is true. Part of one’s basis for knowing that r might be that one has reason to believe that there is no strong evidence against r. But if one were to learn of strong evidence against r, such as testimony that one’s car had been towed, one ought, at least in some cases, to consider the possibility that one does not in fact know that r, rather than simply inferring that the testimony is misleading. Learning the truth of the antecedent – that there is strong evidence against r – may undermine the justification for believing the conditional itself, thus making the conditional resistant to modus ponens. Knowledge of the conditional depends on one’s knowing that the antecedent is false. Finding evidence in favor of the antecedent – even if in fact it is misleading – may weaken one’s justification for the conditional, such that one no longer knows the conditional to be true.

This blocking of the dogmatist argument does not involve denying closure, though. The reason the modus ponens inference fails to go through is because the conditional is a “junk” conditional; one can know the conditional to be true only if one does not know the antecedent to be true, and the closure principle applies only if one simultaneously knows both the conditional and its antecedent to be true.

Another explanation that does not require the denial of closure is due to Michael Veber (Veber 2004). He says that even if the dogmatist argument is sound, the principle “If a piece of evidence E is known by S to be misleading, S ought to disregard it,” ought not to be endorsed on grounds of human fallibility. We are frequently enough wrong in taking ourselves to know what we in fact do not know that following such a principle would lead one to disregard evidence that is not misleading. There is nothing wrong with the principle, provided it is correctly applied; but due to the difficulty or impossibility of correctly applying it, adopting such a policy is contraindicated.

5. The McKinsey Paradox, Closure, and Transmission Failure

a. The McKinsey Paradox

Michael McKinsey (1991) discovered a paradox about content externalism that has prompted some reconsideration of how knowledge is transmitted through deductive reasoning.

Content externalism (or anti-individualism) is, to greatly oversimplify, the thesis that we are only able to have thoughts with certain contents because we inhabit environments of certain sorts. (Putnam 1975 and Burge 1979 are the most notable defenses of this view). Molecule-for-molecule duplicates could differ in their contents due to differences in their environments. According to the externalist, my twin on Twin Earth might be an exact duplicate of me, but if Twin Earth contains a different but similar light metal used to make baseball bats, cans, and so forth instead of aluminum, then even if the denizens of Twin Earth call this metal “aluminum,” their thoughts are not thoughts about aluminum. This view is a repudiation of the Cartesian view of the mental, according to which the contents of our thoughts are what they are independent of the surrounding world.

Externalism has been defended and criticized on many different grounds, but the debate about externalism has pivoted largely on its implications for the thesis that we have privileged access to the contents of our own thoughts. How does one know that she is now thinking that some cans are made from aluminum, rather than the thought that some cans are made from twaluminum (as we may call it), which is what she would be thinking if she lived on Twin Earth? Incompatibilists about externalism and privileged access point out that the two thoughts are introspectively indiscriminable if externalism is true and argue that one could only know which of these thoughts one is now thinking through empirical investigation of one’s environment.

Compatibilists about externalism and self-knowledge often argue that if a subject has a mental state with a particular content (say, a belief that some cans are made of aluminum) in virtue of that subject bearing a certain relation to an external state of affairs (say, aluminum, rather than twaluminum, being present in one’s environs), then any mental state the subject has about that particular mental state of his, like his belief that he believes some cans are made of aluminum, will also stand in a similar relation to the same external state of affairs (aluminum, rather than twaluminum, being present). Hence, this second-order mental state (i.e. a mental state about a mental state) will involve the same content as the first-order belief (say, that some cans are made of aluminum). In short, one will believe that he believes cans are made of aluminum only if one in fact does believe that cans are made of aluminum, since both of these states bear a causal relation to aluminum, rather than twaluminum. (See Burge 1988 and Heil 1988). Whatever makes it the case that S thinks that p (instead of q) will also make it the case that S thinks I am thinking that p (instead of I am thinking that q). Coupled with a reliabilist theory of knowledge, these second-order beliefs count as knowledge since they cannot go wrong and the thesis of privileged access is reconciled with externalism.

Enter McKinsey’s Paradox. We assume that we know content externalism to be true and that it is compatible with a suitably robust thesis of privileged access to thought contents. We may now reason as follows:

1. I know that I am in mental state M (say, the state of believing that water is wet). (Privileged Access)
2. I know that if I am in mental state M, then I meet external conditions E (say, living in an environment that contains water). (Content Externalism, known through philosophical reflection)
3. If I know one thing and I know that it entails a second thing, then I know the second thing. (Closure of knowledge under known entailment)
4. Thus, I know that I meet external conditions E. (From 1-3)

The knowledge attributed in the premises is a priori in the broad sense that includes knowledge gotten through introspection and/or philosophical reflection. That knowledge is not gained via empirical investigation of the external world. The conclusion follows by an application of the closure principle. What is paradoxical is that, given closure, it seems that one can know the truth of an empirical claim about the external world (say, that one’s environment contains water or that it contains aluminum rather than twaluminum) simply by inferring it from truths known by reflection or introspection. This argument bolsters the incompatibilist’s case: since it is only by investigation of the world that one can know that one meets a particular set of external conditions and since the premises (including closure) entail that this fact can be known on the basis of knowledge not dependent on investigation of the world, either the privileged access premise or the externalist thesis must be false (provided that the closure principle is correct).

b. Davies, Wright, and the Closure/Transmission Distinction

There are many responses to this argument. Some reject externalism, some (like McKinsey) deny privileged access, and some compatibilists (Brueckner 1992) argue that even if externalism is known to be true, nothing as specific as the second premise of the argument could be known a priori. But perhaps the most influential attempt to solve the paradox is due to Martin Davies (1998) and Crispin Wright (2000). They argue that even though arguments like McKinsey’s are valid and their premises are known to be true, this knowledge is not transmitted across the entailment to the conclusion. At first blush, it seems like Davies and Wright are rejecting closure, which is certainly one way to deal with the paradox. Davies and Wright accept closure, though, and only reject a related but stronger epistemological principle that says that knowledge is transmitted over known entailment.

Davies and Wright are distinguishing between the closure of knowledge under known entailment and what they take to be a common misreading of it. The closure principle says that if one knows that p and knows that p entails q, then one knows that q, but the principle is silent on what one’s basis or justification for q is and does not claim that the basis for q is the knowledge that p and that p entails q. The principle of the transmission of knowledge under known entailment, however, states that if one knows that p, and knows that p entails q, then one knows q on that basis – what enables one to know that p and that p entails q also enables one to know that q. Davies and Wright accept the closure principle but deny the transmission principle, arguing that it fails when the inference from p to q is, although valid, not cogent. Here cogency is understood as an argument’s aptness for producing rational conviction.

One way an argument could be valid but fail to be cogent is that the justification for the premises presupposes the truth of the conclusion. If I reason from the premise that I have a drivers license issued by the state of North Carolina (based on visual inspection of my license and memory of having obtained it at the North Carolina Department of Motor Vehicles) to the conclusion that there exists an external world, including North Carolina, outside my mind, it is plausible that my justification for the premise (taking sense experience and memory at face value) presupposes the truth of the conclusion. If this is so, then it seems that the premise could not be my basis for knowing the conclusion. Anyone in doubt about the conclusion would not accept the premise, so although the premise entails the conclusion, the premise could not provide the basis for rational conviction that the conclusion is true. Such an argument is valid, but not cogent. It would not be a counterexample to closure, for anyone who knows the premise and the entailment also must know the conclusion, but it is a counterexample to the transmission principle, since the conclusion would not be known on the basis of the knowledge of the premise.

According to Davies and Wright, the McKinsey argument is valid but not cogent because knowledge of the conclusion is presupposed in one’s supposed introspective knowledge of the premises. Thus, it is a counterexample to transmission, but poses no threat to closure. The non-empirical access to the externally individuated thought contents is conditional on the assumption that certain external conditions obtain (such as that one’s environs include aluminum rather than twaluminum), which can only be confirmed empirically. Thus one may not reason from the non-empirical knowledge claimed in the premises to non-empirical knowledge of an empirical truth that enjoys presuppositional status with regard to the premises. That one has a thought about water may entail that one bears a causal relation to water in one’s environment (if externalism is correct) and one may know the former and the entailment only if one knows the latter, but one may not cogently reason from the premise to the conclusion, since the inference begs the question. Anyone who doubts the conclusion of the McKinsey argument in the first place would not (or at least should not — the presuppositions of our premises are not always recognized as such) be moved to accept the premises that entail it.

Consider then the following principle about a priori knowledge:

(APK) If a subject knows something a priori and correctly deduces (a priori) from it a second thing, then the subject knows a priori the second claim.

We can describe this principle in two equivalent ways. It is the principle of closure of a priori knowledge under correct a priori deduction and, alternatively, it is a specific instance of the principle of transmission of knowledge under known entailment, since it claims that the a priori basis for knowledge of the premise transmits to the conclusion, allowing it to be known a priori as well. If Davies and Wright are correct, the principle is false because counterexamples may be found in deductions that are valid but not cogent.

Davies and Wright apply this distinction between transmission and closure to Moore’s anti-skeptical argument as well. Although it is true that the negation of the brain-in-a-vat hypothesis is entailed by an ordinary proposition, such as that I have hands, the existence of the external world is presupposed in the justification for that premise and, therefore, may not be justifiably inferred from that premise. Moore’s argument is not cogent, so it is a counterexample to transmission, which we have reason to reject anyhow, and not a counterexample to closure (or so Davies and Wright argue).

This is plausibly another sort of conditional that is not expandable by modus ponens. Unlike the junk conditionals, which cannot be expanded because the conditional can be known to be true only when the antecedent of the conditional is not known to be true, conditionals in which the justification for the antecedent presupposes justification for the consequent – we may call them conditionals of presupposition – cannot be expanded because the relevant modus ponens inference would not be cogent. The inference would be question-begging.

The distinction that Davies and Wright argue for also applies to closure principles for justified belief. If they are correct, then justified belief could be closed under known entailment even if justification is not necessarily transmitted across known entailment. The counterexamples to the transmission principle for knowledge would also function as counterexamples for the transmissibility of justified belief.

Some have argued that the Davies-Wright line of argument fails to solve the McKinsey paradox. Whether they are right is beyond the scope of this entry. But the distinction Davies and Wright have drawn between transmission and closure is an important one. That if one knows that p and has validly deduced q from p, one must know that q, tells us nothing about one’s basis for q. Although quite often it can and will, in some instances knowledge of p cannot provide the basis for knowledge of q, even though p entails q, because the justification for p presupposes q. One knows that q (on some independent basis), so there is no counterexample to closure, but q will not be known on the basis of p, so the transmission principle is false.

Clarifying the closure principle as a principle about the distribution of knowledge across known entailment, rather than as a principle about the transmission or acquisition of knowledge, divorces the closure principle, to some extent, from the initial intuitive support for it, which is the idea that we can add to our store of knowledge (or justified belief) by accepting what we know to be entailed by propositions we know (or justifiably believe). On this understanding of closure, knowledge and justified belief are distributed across known entailment even when drawing the inference in question could not add to one’s store of knowledge or justified belief.

6. Ordinary Propositions, Lottery Propositions, and Closure

The closure principle also figures in a paradox about our knowledge of “ordinary propositions” and “lottery propositions.” Ordinary propositions are those that we ordinarily suppose ourselves to know. Lottery propositions are those with a high likelihood of being true, but which we are ordinarily disinclined to say that we know. Suppose that one lives on a fixed income and struggles to make ends meet. It seems that one knows one will not be able to afford a mansion on the French Riviera this year. One’s not being able to afford the mansion this year entails that one will not win the big lottery this year. By the closure principle, since one knows that one will not be able to afford the mansion and one knows that one’s not being able to afford the mansion entails that one will not win the lottery, one must know that one will not win the lottery. Most, however, are disinclined to say that one could know that one will not win the lottery. There’s always a chance, after all (provided that one buys a ticket).

This phenomenon is widespread. Ordinarily, one who keeps up with politics could be said to know that Dick Cheney is the U.S. Vice-President. That Cheney is the Vice-President entails that Cheney did not die of a heart attack thirty seconds ago. But it seems that one does not know that Cheney did not die of a heart attack in the last thirty seconds. How could one know such a thing? (The coining of the term “lottery proposition” and the discovery that this phenomenon is widespread, is due to Jonathan Vogel).

The apparently inconsistent triad is (i) one knows the ordinary proposition, (ii) one fails to know the lottery proposition, and (iii) closure. One may eliminate the inconsistency by denying closure on the sort of grounds that Dretske and Nozick cite. Plausibly, one’s belief of so-called ordinary propositions tracks the truth, while one’s belief of lottery propositions does not. If Cheney were not Vice-President, one would not believe he was, but had Cheney died in the past thirty seconds, one still would believe he was Vice-President.

One might bite the skeptical bullet and insist that one really does not know that Cheney is Vice-President. One of a more anti-skeptical bent might maintain that one can really know the lottery propositions, such as that Cheney did not die in the last thirty seconds. Such a resolution has considerable costs, but denying closure is not among them.

Alternatively, one might argue for a contextualist handling of the problem that does not require the denial of closure or biting the skeptical or anti-skeptical bullet.

7. References and Further Reading

a. References

• Audi, Robert (1988), Belief, Justification and Knowledge, Belmont: Wadsworth.
  • Argues against closure to avoid dogmatic conclusion.
• Audi, Robert (1991), “Justification, Deductive Closure and Reasons to Believe,” Dialogue, 30: 77-84.
  • Argues against closure to avoid dogmatic conclusion.
• Brueckner, Anthony (1992), “What an Anti-Individualist Knows A Priori,” Analysis 52: 111-118.
  • Solution to the McKinsey paradox that does not deny closure.
• Brueckner, Anthony (2004), “Strategies for Refuting Closure,” Analysis 64: 333-35.
  • Reply to Warfield 2004 and Hales 1995.
• Brueckner, Anthony; Fiocco, M. Oreste (2002), “Williamson’s Anti-Luminosity Argument,” Philosophical Studies, 110: 285-293.
  • Contains putative counterexample to Dretskean account of knowledge.
• Burge, Tyler (1979), “Individualism and the Mental,” Midwest Studies in Philosophy, 4: 73-122.
  • Seminal defense of content externalism (or anti-individualism).
• Burge, Tyler (1988), “Individualism and Self-Knowledge,” The Journal of Philosophy, 85: 649-663.
  • Influential reconciliation of content externalism and the privileged access theses.
• Davies, Martin (1998), “Externalism, Architecturalism, and Epistemic Warrant,” in C. MacDonald, B. Smith and C. J. G. Wright (eds.), 321-361.
  • Argues that McKinsey paradox is a counterexample to transmission, not closure.
• Dretske, Fred (1970), “Epistemic Operators,” The Journal of Philosophy, 67: 1007-1023.
  • Seminal paper arguing against the closure of knowledge.
• Dretske, Fred (1971), “Conclusive Reasons,” Australasian Journal of Philosophy, 49: 1-22.
  • Contains Dretske’s account of knowledge.
• Dretske, Fred (2005a), “The Case against Closure,” in Steup and Sosa (eds.), 13-26.
  • Argues that denying closure is only way to avoid skepticism.
• Dretske, Fred (2005b), “Reply to Hawthorne,” in Steup and Sosa (eds.), 43-46.
  • Reply to Hawthorne 2005.
• Feldman, Richard (1995), “In Defence of Closure,” The Philosophical Quarterly, 45: 487-494.
  • Defends closure against Audi’s arguments (Audi 1988, 1991).
• Grice, Paul (1989), Studies in the Ways of Words, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
  • Classic treatment of pragmatic/semantic distinction, and conversational maxims and implicatures. Relevant to discussion of the tracking theory of knowledge’s “abominable conjunctions.”
• Gunderson, Keith (ed.) (1975), Language, Mind and Knowledge, Minnesota Studies in the Philosophy of Science, volume VII, Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press.
  • Contains seminal Putnam 1975 article.
• Hales, Steven (1995), “Epistemic Closure Principles,” The Southern Journal of Philosophy 33: 185-201.
  • Produces counterexamples to many different formulations of the closure principle, but points out that one cannot refute closure for knowledge by showing that some necessary condition for knowledge fails to be closed.
• Harman, Gilbert (1973), Thought, Princeton: Princeton University Press.
  • Employs closure principle in formulating dogmatic argument.
• Hawthorne, John (2004), Knowledge and Lotteries, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Argues for quasi-contextualist solution to problem of lottery propositions, and defends closure.
• Hawthorne, John (2005), “The Case for Closure,” in Steup and Sosa (eds.), 26-43.
  • Defends closure against Dretske’s 2005a arguments.
• Heil, John (1988), “Privileged Access,” Mind 97: 238-251.
  • Influential reconciliation of content externalism and privileged access theses.
• MacDonald, Cynthia; Smith, Barry; Wright, Crispin (1998), Knowing Our Own Minds: Essays on Self-Knowledge, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Contains the Davies 1998 article.
• McKinsey, Michael (1991), “Anti-Individualism and Privileged Access,” Analysis 51: 9-16.
  • Formulation of the McKinsey paradox.
• Moore, G.E. (1959), Philosophical Papers, London: George Allen and Unwin, Ltd.
  • Contains seminal anti-skeptical essays, such as “Proof of an External World,” and “A Defence of Common Sense.”
• Nozick, Robert (1981), Philosophical Explanations, Cambridge: Harvard University Press.
  • Influential tracking account of knowledge and consequent denial of closure.
• Putnam, Hilary (1975), “The Meaning of ‘Meaning’,” in K. Gunderson (ed.), 131-193.
  • Seminal work defending content externalism.
• Roth, Michael (ed.) (1990), Doubting: Contemporary Perspectives on Skepticism, Dordrecht: Kluwer.
  • Contains Vogel 1990.
• Sorensen, Roy (1988), “Dogmatism, Junk Knowledge and Conditionals,” The Philosophical Quarterly, 38: 433-454.
  • Solves dogmatism puzzle without denying closure.
• Steup, Matthias, and Sosa, Ernest, (eds.) (2005), Contemporary Debates in Epistemology, Malden MA: Blackwell Publishing.
  • Contains Dretske-Hawthorne exchange on closure.
• Thalberg, Irving (1974), “Is Justification Transmissible Through Deduction?” Philosophical Studies 25: 347-356.
  • Argues for counterexample to closure in dogmatism examples.
• Unger, Peter (1975), Ignorance: A Case for Scepticism, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Retains closure but offers skeptical resolution of the dogmatism puzzle.
• Veber, Michael (2004), “What do you do with Misleading Evidence?” The Philosophical Quarterly 54: 557-569.
  • Reply to Sorensen (1988) and alternative solution to dogmatism puzzle.
• Vogel, Jonathan (1990), “Are There Counterexamples to the Closure Principle?” in M. Roth (ed.).
  • Influential discussion of closure and lottery propositions.
• Wright, Crispin (2000), “Cogency and Question-Begging: Some reflections of McKinsey’s Paradox and Putnam’s Proof,” Philosophical Issues 10: 140-163.
  • On the distinction between closure and transmission, and McKinsey’s paradox.

b. Further Reading

• Brueckner, Anthony (1985), “Transmission for Knowledge not Established,” The Philosophical Quarterly 35: 193-95.
  • Reply to Forbes 1984.
• Brueckner, Anthony (2000), “Klein on Closure and Skepticism,” Philosophical Studies 98: 139-151.
  • Reply to Klein 1995.
• DeRose, Keith (1995), “Solving the Skeptical Problem,” Philosophical Review 104: 1-52.
  • Influential defense of contextualist epistemology.
• Forbes, Graeme (1984), “Nozick on Scepticism,” The Philosophical Quarterly 34: 43-52.
  • Argues that Nozick’s denial of closure cannot adequately handle cases of inferential knowledge.
• Goldman, Alvin (1976), “Discrimination and Perceptual Knowledge,” Journal of Philosophy 73: 771-791.
  • Defends reliabilist account of knowledge that denies closure, and contains a helpful discussion of the notion of a relevant alternative.
• Klein, Peter (1981), Certainty: A Refutation of Skepticism, Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press.
  • Argues that defense of knowledge closure assumes internalism about justification, so the skeptic who uses the principle begs the question against the externalist anti-skeptic.
• Klein, Peter (1995), “Skepticism and Closure: Why the Evil Genius Argument Fails,” Philosophical Topics 23: 213-236.
  • Offers a defense of closure for justification, which, whether the defense succeeds or fails, he says refutes the skeptic.
• Luper (-Foy), Steven, (1987), “The Causal Indicator Analysis of Knowledge,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 47: 563-587.
  • Argues for a tracking account of knowledge that retains closure.
• Pritchard, Duncan (2002), “McKinsey Paradoxes, Radical Scepticism, and the Transmission of Knowledge Across Known Entailments,” Synthese 130: 279-302.
  • Reply to Martin and Davies on Transmission and McKinsey paradox.
• Salmon, Nathan (1989), “Illogical Belief,” Philosophical Perspectives 3: 243-285.
  • Argues that his Millian account of names and belief produces counterexamples to closure principles of justification and knowledge.
• Silins, Nicholas (2005), “Transmission Failure Failure,” Philosophical Studies 126: 71-102.
  • Argues against the Davies-Wright line on transmission failure.
• Sosa, Ernest (1999), “How to Defeat Opposition to Moore,” Philosophical Perspectives 13: 141-152.
  • Adjustment of the tracking account of knowledge that allows it to sustain closure.
• Stine, Gail (1971), “Dretske on Knowing the Logical Consequences,” Journal of Philosophy 68: 296-299.
  • Reply to Dretske 1970.
• Warfield, Ted (2004), “When Epistemic Closure Does and Does not Fail: a Lesson from the History of Epistemology,” Analysis 64: 35-41.
  • Points out that one cannot refute closure for knowledge by showing that some necessary condition for knowledge fails to be closed.

Author Information

John M. Collins
Email: collinsjo@ecu.edu
East Carolina University
U. S. A.