Personal Identity

What does being the person that you are, from one day to the next, necessarily consist in? This is the question of personal identity, and it is literally a question of life and death, as the correct answer to it determines which types of changes a person can undergo without ceasing to exist. Personal identity theory is the philosophical confrontation with the most ultimate questions of our own existence: who are we, and is there a life after death? In distinguishing those changes in a person that constitute survival from those changes in a person that constitute death, a criterion of personal identity through time is given. Such a criterion specifies, insofar as that is possible, the necessary and sufficient conditions for the survival of persons.

One popular criterion, associated with Plato, Descartes and a number of world religions, is that persons are immaterial souls or pure egos. On this view, persons have bodies only contingently, not necessarily; so they can live after bodily death. Even though this so-called Simple View satisfies certain religious or spiritual predilections, it faces metaphysical and epistemological obstacles, as we shall see.

Another intuitively appealing view, championed by John Locke, holds that personal identity is a matter of psychological continuity. According to this view, in order for a person X to survive a particular adventure, it is necessary and sufficient that there exists, at a time after the adventure, a person Y who psychologically evolved out of X. This idea is typically cashed out in terms of overlapping chains of direct psychological connections, as those causal and cognitive connections between beliefs, desires, intentions, experiential memories, character traits, and so forth. This Lockean view is well suited for thought experiments conducted from first-person points of view, such as body swaps or tele-transportation, but it, too, faces obstacles. For example, on this view, it appears to be possible for two future persons to be psychologically continuous with a presently existing person. Can one really become two? In response to this problem, some commentators have suggested that, although our beliefs, memories, and intentions are of utmost importance to us, they are not necessary for our identity, our persistence through time.

A third criterion of personal identity is that we are our bodies, that is to say, that personal identity is constituted by some brute physical relation between, for example, different bodies or different life-sustaining systems at different times. Although this view is still somewhat unpopular, developments about personal identity theory in the 1990s promise an ideological change, as versions of the so-called somatic criterion, associated with Eric Olson and Paul Snowdon, attract a continuously growing number of adherents.

The aim of this article is to (1) add precision to the problem of personal identity, (2) state a number of theories of personal identity and give arguments for and against them, (3) formulate “the paradox of identity,” which proposes to show that posing the persistence question, in conjunction with a number of plausible assumptions, leads to a contradiction, and (4) explain how Derek Parfit’s theory of persons attempts to answer this paradox.

Table of Contents

1. Understanding the Problem of Personal Identity
   1. Criteria and the Identity Relation
   2. Personhood
2. Theories of Personal Identity
   1. The Simple View
   2. Reductionism (1): General Features
   3. Reductionism (2): Psychological Approaches
   4. Quasi-Psychology
   5. Reductionism (3): Physiological Approaches
3. The Paradox of Personal Identity
   1. Fission
   2. The Paradox
4. Parfit and the Unimportance of Personal Identity
5. References and Further Reading

1. Understanding the Problem of Personal Identity

The persistence question, the question of what personal identity over time consists in, is literally a question of life and death: answers to it determine, insofar as that is possible, the conditions under which we survive, or cease to exist in the course of, certain adventures. These adventures do not have to be theoretically as fancy as the cases, to be discussed later, of human fission or brain swaps: a theory of personal identity tells us whether we can live through the acquisition of complex cognitive capacities in our development from fetus to person, or whether we have survived car accidents if we find ourselves in a persistent vegetative state. Furthermore, theories of personal identity have ethical and metaphysical implications of considerable magnitude: in conjunction with certain normative premises they may support the justification or condemnation of infanticide or euthanasia, or they could prove or falsify certain aspects of our religious outlook, in deciding the questions of how and whether we can be resurrected and whether we are possessors of souls whose existence conditions are identical with ours. It is not surprising, therefore, that most great philosophers have attempted to solve the problem of personal identity, or have committed themselves to metaphysical systems that have substantial implications with regards to the problem, and that most religious belief systems give explicit answers to the persistence question. Neither is it surprising that virtually everybody holds a pre-theoretical theory of personal identity, if only in the sense of having beliefs about afterlives and the meaning of death. The task of solving the metaphysical problem of personal identity essentially involves answering the question of how the phenomenon or principle in virtue of which “entities like us” persist through time is to be specified, under the widely but not universally accepted premises that there is such a phenomenon or principle and that it can be specified. We are concerned, in other words, with the truth-makers of personal identity statements: what makes it true that our statement that an entity X at time t₁ and an entity Y at time t₂ are identical, if X and Y are entities like us?

a. Criteria and the Identity Relation

Answers to the persistence question often provide a criterion of personal identity. A criterion is a set of non-trivial necessary and sufficient conditions that determines, insofar as that is possible, whether distinct temporally indexed person-stages are stages of one and the same continuant person. (A temporally indexed person-stage is a slice of a continuant person that extends in three spatial dimensions but has no temporal extension.) To say that C is a necessary condition for E is to say that if E is the case, then C is the case as well, and to say that C is a sufficient condition for E is to say that if C is the case, then E is the case as well. Consequently, to specify such a criterion is to give an account of what personal identity necessarily consists in.

Let us distinguish between numerical identity and qualitative identity (exact similarity): X and Y are numerically identical iff X and Y are one thing rather than two, while X and Y are qualitatively identical iff, for the set of non-relational properties F₁…F_n of X, Y only possesses F₁…F_n. (A property may be called “non-relational” if its being borne by a substance is independent of the relations in which property or substance stand to other properties or substances.) Personal identity is an instance of the relation of numerical identity; investigations into the nature of the former, therefore, must respect the formal properties that govern the latter. The concept of identity is uniquely defined by (a) the logical laws of congruence: if X is identical with Y, then all non-relational properties borne by X are borne by Y, or formally “∀(x, y)[(x = y) → (Fx = Fy)]; and (b) reflexivity: every X is identical with itself, or formally “∀x(x = x). (Note that congruence and reflexivity entail that identity is symmetric, “∀(x, y)[(x = y) → (y = x)], and transitive, “∀(x, y, z)[((x = y) & (y = z)) → (x = z)]). [Note: ∀(x, y) is an abbreviation of (∀x)(∀y).]

Grasp of the notion of numerical identity, to be sure, is essential to our ability to distinguish between the events of picking out one thing more often than once and picking out more than one thing. Although exact similarity is, by congruence, a necessary condition for synchronic personal identity, it is neither necessary nor sufficient for diachronic personal identity, that is to say, the persistence of a person over time: two person-slices at different times could be qualitatively identical slices of different people or qualitatively distinct slices of the same person. This is not to say, however, that it is ruled out that lack of similarity over time may obliterate numerical personal identity: depending on what personal identity consists in, certain qualitative changes in a person’s psychology or physiology may kill the person. The question a criterion of personal identity answers is: what kind of changes does a person survive?

This gives a distinctive sense to the claim that a criterion of personal identity is to be constitutive, not merely evidential: in order for a relation R to be constitutive for personal identity, it must be the case that, necessarily, if some past or future Y stands in an R-relation to X, then X is identical with Y. Hence, many elements of our successful everyday reidentification practices, such as physical appearance, fingerprints, or signatures, are inadequate if considered as constituting ingredients of personal identity relations: for example, if the man in the crowd is wearing a Yankees jacket, this might be sufficient evidence for you to conclude that he is your friend Larry. However, wearing a Yankees jacket is not what it is for Larry to persist through time: neither did Larry come into existence when he wore the jacket for the first time nor does he die when he takes it off.

Does the logic of the concept of identity impose further restraints on the concept of personal identity? Some commentators believe that identity is an intrinsic relation, that is, that if two person-stages at different times are stages of one and the same person, that will be true only in virtue of the intrinsic relation between these two stages (cf. Noonan 1989; Wiggins 2001). Others hold identity to be necessarily determinate, that is, that it is necessarily false that sometimes there is no answer to the question of whether X is identical with Y. These commentators typically reason as follows: suppose that it is indeterminate that X is identical with Y. Since it is determinate that X is identical with X, under the assumption that congruence and predicate logic apply, X must be determinately identical with Y. Therefore, by modus tollens, if X is not determinately identical with Y, X is not identical with Y (cf. Evans 1985; Wiggins 2001). Consequently, the question does in fact have an answer, and the claim that identity is indeterminate is self-contradictory. This conclusion is strengthened, in the case of personal identity, by the widely shared intuition that even if the identity of some objects might be indeterminate, this could not be true of the identity of persons: one cannot, it seems, be a bit dead and a bit alive in the same way in which one cannot be a bit pregnant. As it turns out, however, there may be good reasons to deny both the intrinsicness and the determinacy of personal identity (cf. 3.a.; 3.b.).

b. Personhood

While the formal properties of the concept of identity are necessary constraints on our discussion, the truth of our identity judgments is subject to material conditions of correctness, which these formal properties cannot provide. These material conditions must be supplied by the nature of the relata judged to stand in an identity relation. The obvious suggestion is that, given that we are dealing with personal identity, these relata are person-stages located at different times. This proposal, however, violates the requirement that the persistence question ought to specify its relata without presupposing an answer: should we choose to accept a definition in the vicinity of Locke’s characterization of a person as a “thinking, intelligent being, that has reason and reflection, and can consider itself as itself, the same thinking thing in different times and places” (1689, II.xxvii.9), then those criteria of personal identity that sanction the identity of a person at one time with a non-person at another time are categorically ruled out. Fetuses, infants, or human beings in a persistent vegetative state, for example, plainly do not fulfill the criteria envisaged by Locke. As a result, since these beings do not possess cognitive capacities, if they do at all, that qualitatively attain those of thinking beings, couching the persistence question in terms of persons entails that none of us has ever been a fetus or infant or ever will be a human vegetable (Olson 1997a; Mackie 1999). To be sure, these initially baffling claims could be true. However, since these are clearly substantial questions about our persistence, we should not consider ourselves justified to settle the matter by definition. Consequently, we should prefer vagueness over chauvinism and pose the persistence question in terms of the wider notion of human being, postponing the question of whether and in what sense the notions of person and human being ought to be distinguished: for any person X and any human being Y at different times t₁ and t₂, if X at t₁ is numerically identical with Y at t₂, what makes this claim necessarily true?

2. Theories of Personal Identity

In order to discover what your pre-philosophical attitude towards this question is, ask yourself the following: what does a supernatural being have to do in order to resurrect you after you die? Collect a few possible answers and ask yourself whether the resulting being, the freshly created being that is now a candidate for being identical with you before you died, is in fact you. For example, do you believe that

1. …the supernatural being could have given you a body which bears no physical continuity or causal relation to the one you possessed before your death, or that it could have resurrected you, in some sense or other, as a bodiless being?
2. …it could have given a new form or content to your psychology, that is, that it is not necessary or sufficient for the “resurrected you” to remember your actions or experiences and that there do not have to be any causal connections between the actions and experiences of you before you died and the”resurrected you”?
3. …the question of whether or not the resulting person is you depends on the existence, in the resurrected person, of something that one might call “a soul”?

If you believe any of these options, then you must also believe, respectively, that

1. …a physiological criterion of personal identity is false.
2. …a psychological criterion of personal identity is false.
3. …the Simple View of personal identity is true.

Let us discuss these theories of personal identity in more detail.

a. The Simple View

Some commentators believe that there are no informative, non-trivial persistence conditions for people, that is, that personal persistence is an ultimate and unanalyzable fact (cf. Chisholm 1976; Lowe 1996; Merricks 1998; Shoemaker & Swinburne 1984). While psychological and physiological continuities are evidential criteria, these do not constitute necessary and/or sufficient conditions for personal identity. We must distinguish between two versions of this view. One version is that personal identity is non-reductive and wholly non-informative, denying that personal identity follows from anything other than itself. This makes the label Identity Mysticism (“IM“) most appropriate (cf. Zimmerman 1998):

IM: X at t₁ is identical to Y at t₂ iff X at t₁ is identical to Y at t₂,

Identity Mysticism plays only an indirect role in contemporary personal identity theory. Although it may be poorly understood, due to limitations of space this article will disregard the view. IM is to be distinguished from a more popular version of the simple view, according to which personal identity relations are weakly reductive (WR) and in independence non-informative (INI):

WR-INI: X at t₁ is identical to Y at t₂ iff there is some fact F₁ about X at t₁, and some fact F₂ about Y at t₂, and F₁ and F₂ are irreducible to facts about the subjects’ psychology or physiology, and X at t₁ is identical with Y at t₂ in virtue of the fact that the propositions stating F₁ and F₂ differ only insofar as that “X” and “t₁” occur in the former where “Y” and “t₂” occur in the latter.

WR-INI is weakly reductive in the sense that, while the identity relation in question can be reduced to a further domain, the further domain itself typically exhibits elements of non-reducibility and/or resistance to full physical explanation. In their most prominent variants, these elements are due to references to souls, Cartesian Egos or other spiritual or immaterial substances and/or properties. Initially the idea underlying this claim may appear prejudicial; ultimately it is based on a number of widespread but not universally accepted beliefs about the naturalness of the world and the nature, validity and theoretical implications of physicalism. According to this general stance, either both psychological and physiological continuity relations are fully reducible to a domain in which physical explanations are couched, perhaps in terms of the basic elements of a final and unified theory of physics, or they belong themselves to such a domain.

WR-INI may entail IM but does not so necessarily: it is conceivable that personal identity relations consist in something which is itself neither identical with nor reducible to a spiritual substance nor identical with nor reducible to aggregates or parts of psychologies and physiologies. In fact, Descartes’ own view that personal identity is determined by “vital union” relations between pure Egos and bodies, with the persistence of the Ego being regarded as sufficient for the persistence of the person but the person not being wholly identifiable with the Ego, could be a weakly reductive view of persons. It is merely weakly reductive, however, because the identity of the phenomenon that specifies the necessary and sufficient conditions for personal identity does not itself follow from anything other than itself. While a weakly reductive criterion of personal identity relations is explicable in terms of the identities of phenomena other than persons, the identities of these phenomena themselves are not explicable in other terms: their identity may be, as we would suppose “soul identity” to be, “strict and philosophical”, and not merely “loose and popular” (Butler 1736).

Nowadays, the Simple View is disparaged as a theory only maintained by thinkers whose religious or spiritual commitments outweigh the reasons that speak against their views on personal identity. This is due to the fact that it is assumed that a theory of personal identity cannot be weakly reductive without involving appeal to discredited spiritual substances or committing itself either to the acknowledgment of yet unrecognized physical entities or to an Identity Mysticism on the level of persons. As a consequence, many philosophers think that the problems that infiltrate dualism and Cartesian theories of the soul, such as the alleged impossibilities to circumscribe the ontological status of souls and to explain how a soul can interact with a body, render the Simple View equally problematic. Although the options mentioned are exceedingly difficult to defend, why should they have to be regarded as the only options available to the Simple Theorist? Arguably, many respectable philosophical ideologies, such as conceptualism or Neo-Kantianism, may issue in theories of personal identity along Simple lines without appeal to Cartesian Egos. (Note, however, that these ideologies, with regards to the problem of the persistence of people, may also be, and in fact have been, construed along physiological or psychological lines). This suggests that we do not only need a better understanding, and above all more promising articulations, of the Simple View, but also a new taxonomy of theories of personal identity: the traditional division of theories into Simple, Psychological and Physical, even if maintained here by the author of this entry, may not be the best way of viewing the matter.

b. Reductionism (1): General Features

Modern day personal identity theory takes place mainly within reductionist assumptions, concentrating on the relative merits of different criteria of identity and related methodological questions. Reductionist theories of personal identity share the contention that…

Reduction: Facts about personal identity stand in an adequate reduction-relation to sets of sub-personal facts SF₁ … SF_n about psychological and/or physiological continuities in such a way as to issue in biconditionals of the form “X at t₁ is identical to Y at t₂ iff X at t₁ and Y at t₂ stand in a continuity-relation fully describable by SF_x.”

Thus, any given set of sub-personal facts will impose demands, in forms of necessary and sufficient conditions, upon the kinds of adventures a subject can survive in persisting from t₁ to t₂. The sets of necessary and sufficient conditions determined by these sets of sub-personal facts constitute the various criteria of personal identity. It must be noted that the biconditionals in question need not to be understood in such a way as that circularity is an objection to them: provided that concepts other than “person” feature in the analysans, these biconditionals, by exhibiting connections with collateral and independently intelligible concepts, may be genuinely elucidatory even if the concept to be analyzed features on both sides of the equation (cf. McDowell 1997; Wittgenstein 1922, 3.263).

Only when the concepts “person” and “personal identity” become the target of what may be referred to as an authentic reduction circularities become vicious. The need for the distinction between authentic and inauthentic reductions arises due to an equivocation that ought not to confuse the present discussion: reductionisms in personal identity theory often take forms, if regarded for example as sets of supervenience claims, that are deemed, in other areas of analytic philosophy, as distinctively non-reductionist. Let us speak of authentic reductions if the ontological status of members of the reduced category is, in a way to be made precise, diminished in favor of the allegedly “more fundamental” existence-status of members of the reducing category. The question of whether an authentic reductionism about persons must claim that it is not only able to give a criterion of personal identity without presupposing personal identity but also that facts about persons are describable without using the concept “person” is a matter of current controversy (cf. Behrendt 2003; Cassam 1989; 1992; Johnston 1997; McDowell 1997; Parfit 1984; 1999; forthcoming; cf. also 2.d.).

In a search for the necessary and sufficient conditions for the sustenance of personal identity relations between subjects, which type of continuity-relations could SF describe? There are two main contenders, physiological continuity-relations and psychological continuity-relations, which will be discussed in turn.

c. Reductionism (2): Psychological Approaches

Psychological Criteria of personal identity hold that psychological continuity relations, that is, overlapping chains of direct psychological connections, as those causal and cognitive connections between beliefs, desires, intentions, experiential memories, character traits and so forth, constitute personal identity (cf. Locke 1689, II.xxvii.9-29; Parfit 1971a; 1984; Perry 1972; Shoemaker 1970; Shoemaker & Swinburne 1984).

Two apparently physiological theories of personal identity are at bottom psychological, namely (i) the Brain Criterion, which holds that the spatiotemporal continuity of a single functioning brain constitutes personal identity; and (ii) the Physical Criterion, which holds that, necessarily, the spatiotemporal continuity of that which sustains the continuous psychological life of a human being over time, which is, contingently, a sufficient part of the brain that must remain in order to be the brain of a living person, constitutes personal identity (cf. Nagel 1971). These approaches are at bottom psychological because they single out, as the constituting factors of personal identity, the psychological continuity of the subject. Consider a test case. Imagine there to be a tribe of beings who are in all respects like human beings, except for the fact that their brains and livers have swapped bodily functions: their brains regulate, synthesize, store, secrete, transform, and break down many different substances in the body, while their livers are responsible for their cognitive capacities, basic integrated postural and locomotor movement sequences, perception, instincts, emotions, thinking, and other integrative activities. Imagine the brain criterion to be true for human beings. Would we have sufficient reason to believe the brain criterion to be true for members of the tribe in question as well, if we were aware of all facts about their physiologies? No, precisely because the brain criterion is true for human beings, a liver criterion would have to be true for members of this tribe. There is nothing special about the 1.3 kilograms of grey mass that we carry around in our skulls, except for the fact that this mass is the seat of our cognitive capacities.

We can further distinguish between three versions of the psychological criterion: the Narrow version demands psychological continuity to be caused “normally,” the Wide version permits any reliable cause, and the Widest version allows any cause to be sufficient to secure psychological continuity (cf. Parfit 1984). The Narrow version, we may note, is logically equivalent to the Physical Criterion.

One might think that brain criterion and physical criterion, to varying degrees, combine the best of both worlds: both acknowledge the vital function psychological continuity plays in our identity judgments while at the same time admitting of the importance of physiological instantiation. In fact, however, the opposite is the case: the appeal to physiology introduces an unacceptable element of contingency into the answers to the persistence question envisaged by defenders of these criteria. A criterion of personal identity tells us what our persistence necessarily consists in, which means that it must be able to deliver a verdict in possible scenarios that is consistent with its verdicts in ordinary cases. One scenario that has been widely debated is the following:

Teletransportation

At t₁, X enters a teletransporter, which, before destroying X, creates an exact blueprint of X’s physical and psychological states. The information is sent to a replicator device on Mars, which at t₂ creates a qualitatively identical duplicate, Y (cf. Parfit 1984). Our alleged intuition: since Y at t₂ shares with X at t₁ all memories, character traits, and other psychological characteristics, X and Y are identical. Alleged conclusion: should teletransportation be reliable, all proposed criteria but the Wide and Widest versions of the Psychological Criterion are false.

Should teletransportation be unreliable, all criteria of personal identity but the Widest version of the Psychological Criterion are false. Consequently, should appeal to such scenarios as Teletransportation be acceptable and should the intuition above be widely shared, the brain criterion and physical criterion are false.

d. Quasi-Psychology

Many people regard the idea that our persistence is intrinsically related to our psychology as obvious. The problem of cashing out this conviction in theoretical terms, however, is notoriously difficult. Psychological continuity relations are to be understood in terms of overlapping chains of direct psychological connections, that is, those causal and cognitive connections between beliefs, desires, intentions, experiential memories, character traits and so forth. This statement avoids two obvious problems.

First, some attempts to cash out personal identity relations in psychological terms appeal exclusively to direct psychological connections. These accounts face the problem that identity is a transitive relation (see 1.a.) while many psychological connections are not. Take memory as an example: suppose that Paul broke the neighbor’s window as a kid, an incident he remembers vividly when he starts working as a primary school teacher in his late 20s. As an old man, Paul remembers his early years as a teacher, but has forgotten ever having broken the neighbor’s window. Assume, for reductio, that personal identity consists in direct memory connections. In that case the kid is identical with the primary school teacher and the primary school teacher is identical with the old man; the old man, however, is not identical with the kid. Since this conclusion violates the transitivity of identity (which states that if an X is identical with a Y, and the Y is identical with a Z, then the X must be identical with the Z), personal identity relations cannot consist in direct memory connections. Appeal to overlapping layers or chains of psychological connections avoids the problem by permitting indirect relations: according to this view, the old man is identical with the kid precisely because they are related to each other by those causal and cognitive relations that connect kid and teacher and teacher and old man.

Second, memory alone is not necessary for personal identity, as lack of memory through periods of sleep or coma do not obliterate one’s survival of these states. Appeal to causal and cognitive connections which relate not only memory but other psychological aspects is sufficient to eradicate the problem. Let us say that we are dealing with psychological connectedness if the relations in question are direct causal or cognitive relations, and that we are dealing with psychological continuity if overlapping layers of psychological connections are appealed to (cf. Parfit 1984).

One of the main problems a psychological approach faces is overcoming an alleged circularity associated with explicating personal identity relations in terms of psychological notions. Consider memory as an example. It seems that if John remembers having repaired the bike, then it is necessarily the case that John repaired the bike: saying that a person remembers having carried out an action which the person did not in fact carry out may be regarded as a misapplication of the verb “to remember.” To be sure, one can remember that an action was carried out by somebody else; it seems to be a matter of necessity, however, that one can only have first-person memories of experiences one had or actions one carried out. Consequently, the objection goes, if memory and other psychological predicates are not impartial with regards to identity judgments, a theory that involves these predicates and that at the same time proposes to explicate such identity judgments is straightforwardly circular: it plainly assumes what it intends to prove.

To make things clearer, consider the case of Teletransportation above: if at t₂ Y on Mars remembers having had at t₁ X’s experience on earth that the coffee is too hot, then, necessarily, X at t₁ is identical with Y at t₂. The dialectic of such thought experiments, however, requires that a description of the scenario is possible that does not presuppose the identity of the participants in question. We would wish to say that since X and Y share all psychological features, it is reasonable or intuitive to judge that X and Y are identical, and precisely not that since we describe the case as one in which there is a continuity between X’s and Y’s psychologies, X and Y are necessarily identical. If some psychological predicates presuppose personal identity in this way, an account of personal identity which constitutively appeals to such predicates is viciously circular.

In response, defenders of the psychological approach have created psychological concepts that share with our ordinary psychological predicates all features except presumptions of personal identity: for example, the concept of “quasi-memory” is exactly like ordinary memory apart from the fact that “memory” is judgmental with regards to personal identity whereas “quasi-memory” is not (cf. Shoemaker 1970). While many commentators regard the appeal to quasi-memory, and ultimately “quasi-psychology,” as sufficient to solve the circularity problem, some commentators think that personal concepts infiltrate extensionally articulated psychological concept-systems so deeply that any reductionist programme in personal identity is doomed from the start (cf. Evans 1982; McDowell 1997).

e. Reductionism (3): Physiological Approaches

Opponents of the psychological criterion typically favour a physiological approach. There are at least two of them: (i) the Bodily Criterion holds that the spatiotemporal continuity of a functioning human body constitutes personal identity (cf. Williams 1956-7; 1970; Thompson 1997); and (ii) the Somatic Criterion holds that the spatiotemporal continuity of the metabolic and other life-sustaining organs of a functioning human animal constitutes personal identity (cf. Mackie 1999; Olson 1997a; 1997b; Snowdon 1991; 1995; 1996). It is not obvious that there is a straightforward relation between them, for everything depends on how the notions of “functioning human body” and “life-sustaining organs” are understood. If these notions are understood similarly, the views are (close to) equivalent; the other extreme, even if unlikely to be held, is that the notions are understood differently, to the effect that they are incompatible (if, for example, a functioning human body and its life-sustaining organs could come apart). Physiological approaches have consequences many of us feel uncomfortable with. Consider the following thought experiment:

Body Swap

X’s brain is transplanted into Y’s body. X’s body and Y’s brain are destroyed, the resulting person is Z. Our alleged intuition: since Z shares with X all memories, character traits, and other psychological characteristics, X is identical with Z. Alleged conclusion: the Bodily and the Somatic Criteria are false (cf. Locke 1689, II.xxvii.15; Shoemaker 1963).

Defenders of bodily criterion and somatic criterion typically bite the bullet and argue that it is not the case that X and Y have swapped bodies, but that Y falsely believes to be X, and therefore that Z is identical with Y.

Since the psychological and physiological approaches are mutually exclusive and, we may suppose in the current context, as candidates for an adequate theory of personal identity jointly exhaustive, any objection against the psychological approach is equally an argument for the physiological approach. The initial implausibility of the physiological approach is due to thought experiments that traditionally permeate the personal identity debate and often favour psychological considerations. Defenders of the somatic approach, most notably Olson and Snowdon, have tried to shift the focus to real-life cases in which descriptions along physiological lines look much more promising. Consider:

Human Vegetable

X has at t₁ a motor bicycle accident. The being Y that is transported to the hospital is at t₂ in a persistent vegetative state. Our alleged intuition: X at t₁ is identical with Y at t₂. Alleged conclusion: all views which postulate psychological continuity as a necessary condition are false.

Fetus

Since a fetus does not possess the cognitive capacities necessary to satisfy the demands of the Psychological Criterion, if the latter is true, no person can be identical with a past fetus. Our alleged intuition: Each of us is identical with a past fetus. Alleged conclusion: all views which postulate psychological continuity as a necessary condition are false.

A third problem for the psychological approach is that it implies, supposedly, that we are not human animals (Ayers 1990; Snowdon 1990; Olson 1997a; 2002a). The argument is simple:

Premise 1: Psychological continuity is neither necessary nor sufficient for the persistence of a human animal.

Premise 2: The psychological approach claims that psychological continuity is necessary and/or sufficient for our persistence.

A: for reductio:The psychological approach is true.

B: from 2, A: Psychological continuity is necessary and/or sufficient for our persistence.

Premise 3: Psychological continuity cannot at the same time be (i) necessary and/or sufficient for a thing’s persistence and (ii) neither necessary nor sufficient for the same thing’s persistence.

C: from 1, B, 3: None of us is identical with a human animal.

Premise 2 is implied by the psychological approach. The thought experiments that support premise 1 have already been given: since the human animal each of us is has been a fetus and could end up as a human vegetable, the thought experiments Fetus and Human Vegetable above demonstrate that psychological continuity is not necessary for human animal identity. A variant of Body Swap shows that psychological continuity is not sufficient for human animal identity. Suppose X’s brain to be transplanted into Y’s skull and X’s body and Y’s brain are destroyed. Suppose further that the resulting being Z is psychologically continuous with X. In this case, it does not seem to be the case that the surgeons transplant the human animal X from one head to another. Rather, it seems, the human animal Y receives a new organ, namely a brain. Consequently, psychological continuity is not sufficient for human animal identity and premise 1 holds. Premise 3 seems to be obvious, because its being false would entail that one and the same being can outlive itself, which is absurd. The defender of the physiological approach now argues that

Premise 4: We are human animals.

C: from B, 4: The psychological approach is false.

Premise 5: Physiological and psychological answers to the persistence question are mutually exclusive and jointly exhaustive.

Conclusion: The physiological approach is true.

It may be argued that premise 4 is not a matter of metaphysics but of biological classification. The underlying problem, however, is that it seems undeniable that there is a human animal located where each of us is. If this human animal has persistence conditions different from those that determine our persistence, then there must be two things wherever each of us is located. This conclusion raises important questions and problems a psychological approach must address.

3. The Paradox of Personal Identity

One of the most influential thought experiments in recent personal identity theory is the case of fission.

a. Fission

Fission

X’s brain is removed from X’s body and X’s body is destroyed. X’s brain’s corpus callosum, the bundle of fibres responsible for retaining the capacity of information-transfer between the two brain hemispheres, is severed, leaving two (potentially) equipollent brain hemispheres. The single lower brain is divided and each hemisphere is transplanted into one of two qualitatively identical bodies of the fission outcomes Y₁ and Y₂. Our alleged intuition: since both Y₁ and Y₂ share with X all psychological characteristics, both are candidates for being identical with X: either, in the absence of the other, would have been identical with X. Alleged conclusion: either, on pain of violating the transitivity of identity, the Psychological Criterion is false or the question of whether two person-stages X at t₁ and Y₁ at t₂ are temporal parts of the same person depends on facts concerning not only X and Y₁ but also, in this case, Y₂. In the latter case, a “closest continuer” clause and/or a “no-branching” proviso must complement a psychological continuity analysis (For a development of this case, see Nozick 1981; Parfit 1984; and Wiggins 1967).

Fission scenarios emphasise the difficulty of deciding whether a thought experiment is acceptable or not. They assume the possibility of commissurotomy or brain bisection, that is, the perforation of the corpus callosum, and hemispherectomy, that is, the surgical removal of the cerebral cortex of one brain hemisphere. Commissurotomy was used in epilepsy treatment in the 50’s (cf. Nagel 1971) and hemispherectomies too have been performed in the past. However, fission cases additionally assume the possibility, in some sense or other, of dividing the subcortical regions, and in particular the single lower brain. This is not physically possible without damaging the upper brain functions (cf. Parfit 1984). Many commentators regard fission to be an acceptable challenge to theories of personal identity. Wilkes disagrees: she thinks that our ignorance about what actually happens in these cases jeopardises the theoretical relevance of fission scenarios (cf. 1988). The question of whether or not physically impossible but logically possible scenarios are acceptable remains to be answered.

Should fission be an acceptable scenario, it presents problems for the the psychological approach in particular. The fission outcomes Y₁ and Y₂ are both psychologically continuous with X. According to the psychological approach, therefore, they are both identical with X. By congruence, however, they are not identical with each other: Y₁ and Y₂ share many properties, but even at the very time the fission operation is completed differ with regards to others, such as spatio-temporal location. Consequently, fission cases seem to show that the psychological approach entails that a thing could be identical with two non-identical things, which of course violates the transitivity of identity. Some commentators have attempted to save the psychological approach by appeal to the so-called “multiple occupancy view,” that is, the claim that, despite appearances, X was two people, namely Y₁ and Y₂, all along (cf. Lewis 1976; Noonan 1989; Perry 1972). Combined with a four-dimensionalist or temporal part ontology, this view is not as absurd as it initially seems, but it is certainly controversial.

Others have acknowledged, as a consequence of fission scenarios, that psychological continuity is not sufficient for personal identity. These commentators typically complement their psychological theory with a non-branching proviso and/or a closest continuer clause. The former states that even though X would survive as Y₁ or Y₂ if the other did not exist, given that the other does exist, X ceases to exist. This proviso avoids the problem of violating the transitivity of identity. It is hard to believe, however, because it entails that I can kill you without you ever noticing: if I knock you unconscious, transplant one of your brain hemispheres into a different body, and drop you off at home before you wake up, then, if the transplant is successful and the psychological approach with non-branching proviso is true, you are dead. We could avoid this problem by adding a closest-continuer or best candidate clause, stating roughly that the best candidate for survival in a fission scenario, that is, the fission outcome which bears the most or the most important resemblances to the original person X, is identical with X. One of the problems with this suggestion is that it assumes that personal identity is an extrinsic relation. It thereby violates another important principle, namely the so-called “only X and Y rule,” which states, roughly, that if two person-stages at different times are stages of one and the same person, that will be true only in virtue of the intrinsic relation between these two stages (cf. Noonan 1989; Wiggins 2001). While this principle is not necessarily sacrosanct, it is desirable to avoid violating it.

b. The Paradox

The upshot of the preceding discussion is that we find ourselves in a perplexing situation. Let the underlying assumption be that there is a criterion of personal identity. The starting point of the debate has been that

Premise 1: A criterion of personal identity captures all those aspects of our existence that are necessary and sufficient for our persistence.

Premise 2: Our persistence is determinate.

A: from 1, 2: A criterion of personal identity determines for every possible past event e₀ and future event e₂, within the boundaries of an adequate delineation of the modality in question, whether a person X at t₁ is identical with the being that has participated in e₀ and the being that will participated in e₂.

Premise 3: Personal identity relations are factual: criteria of personal identity are determined neither by conventions, norms, or other social or personal preferences, however basic, nor by analytic matters about the meaning of concepts. Their truth is, literally, a matter of life and death.

B: from A, 3: There is a factual relation R between a person X at t₁ and a being Y at t₀/t₂ which, for every possible scenario, determines whether X at t₁ is identical with Y at t₀/t₂.

Now, if we agree with the tentative conclusion that there is, at present, no satisfactory simple view of personal identity, then we assent to the claims that

Premise 4: IM and WR–INI are, with respect to a specification of the necessary and sufficient conditions for personal identity, inadequate.

Premise 5: The distinction between IM and WR–INI on the one hand and the reductionist views sketched in I.A.4 on the other is exclusive.

C: from 4, 5: The only feasible candidates for R are relations of physiological and/or psychological continuity.

Since B demands that R holds for every possible scenario, within the limits of an adequate delineation of the modality in question, a criterion of personal identity must deliver compatible judgments on the thought experiments sketched above. However, since these thought experiments deliver conflicting intuitions about which criterion is true, it cannot be the case that more than one such criterion is true. From this it follows that

Premise 6: Physiological and psychological criteria of personal identity are incompatible, that is, R cannot be a conjunction of physiological and psychological relations as well as issuing in determinate and compatible solutions to each thought experiment.

Now, if we are also prepared to accept the

Big Assumption: A criterion of identity must accept all alleged conclusions of the thought experiments sketched in I.A.5

then we must conclude that

D: from B, 6A: Neither physiological nor psychological continuity is both necessary and sufficient for personal identity.

The problem with D is that, in conjunction with premises 2, 4, and 5, it reduces the underlying assumption that there can be an informative criterion of personal identity ad absurdum. This argument may be referred to as the Paradox of Personal Identity.

One should refrain from drawing precipitate conclusions from its defining characteristic as a paradox, that is, the fact that denying any of its premises leads to a conclusion that either violates our intuitions or, in the case of 4, 5, and C, commits one to a philosophically disreputable stance. Rather, the Paradox should be regarded as the starting point of any discussion of personal identity, in the sense that taking a stand on its individual premises bestows the various criteria of personal identity with their distinctive features. However, given that the paradox obliges us, in one way or other, to revise our pre-philosophical beliefs, a theory of personal identity should aim at meeting what will be referred to as the Adequacy Constraint AC on theories of personal identity, which demands that

AC: We ought to sanction a substantial revision of our pre-philosophical views of our metaphysical nature only on the conditions that (i) we receive an explanation of the unreliability of our intuiting faculties that in this domain outweighs our grounds for, and in other domains is compatible with, believing in their reliability; (ii) we receive an approximate demarcation of the extents to which we have to abandon our pre-philosophical beliefs and to which we can and we cannot have knowledge about ourselves.

How is the Paradox to be resolved? A, B, C, and D are deductions, and premise 1 is plausible on independent grounds. If identity is determinate, then premise 1 is true. Consequently, those arguments that deny the possibility of vague objects and indeterminate identity, in addition to our intuition that our own identity must be determinate, work in favor of 1. Note that, should personal identity be indeterminate, we might still be able to give a criterion of personal identity, even though such a criterion would then fall short of giving full necessary and sufficient conditions, since in some imaginary case it does not apply.

The denial of premise 3 seems to entail that we have, in a deep sense, an influence on whether we survive a given adventure, namely by possessing a particular normative, experiential, or attitudinal background. This contention may contradict our intuitions more than any thought experiment could. Since we assumed premises 4 and 5, only premises 2 and 6 and the Big Assumption remain. Could one deny premise 6? Given that the determinacy and factuality premises are accepted, It is hard to believe that we could: if a hybrid view were determinately true, a human being could die twice, once when her psychological and once when her physiological capacities cease to function. As a result, most commentators accept 6 but choose to accept a particular criterion in the vicinity of either side of the psychology-physiology divide. This implies that the Big Assumption must either not entail D or be rejected, which can be argued, always assuming that AC is being met, in three ways:

(a) One could define “adequacy of modality” in such a way as to exclude precisely those thought experiments which are problematic for a given criterion. There are two problems with this proposal: first, it is difficult to see how such a definition of adequacy of modality could not be ad hoc. And secondly, the suggestion is insufficient, for some thought experiments circumscribing physically possible scenarios, such as Human Vegetable, trigger incompatible intuitions as well. While some commentators think that Y is identical with X despite X’s loss of cognitive capacities, others regard Y as a living grave stone, nurtured merely for sentimental reasons, in commemoration of the deceased X.

(b) One could deny premise 2 instead, arguing that if personal identity is indeterminate, then our preferred criterion of personal identity does not have to deliver verdicts in all thought-experimental scenarios. This move has the further benefit that we do not have to quarrel with the alleged conclusion of another thought experiment, the combined spectrum:

Combined Spectrum

A spectrum of possible cases is imagined: at the near end, the normal case, X at t₁ is fully psychologically and physiologically continuous with Y at t₂, while at the far end X at t₁ is neither psychologically nor physiologically continuous with Y at t₂. In the intermediate cases, X at t₁ is approximately halfway psychologically and physiologically continuous with Y at t2. Our alleged intuition: towards the near end of the spectrum X at t₁ is identical with Y at t₂ and towards the far end of the spectrum X at t₁ is not identical with Y at t₂. There could not even in principle be evidence for the existence of a sharp borderline between the cases in which X at t₁is and the cases in which X at t₁is not identical with Y at t₂. Hence, it is implausible to believe that such a borderline exists. Alleged conclusion: personal identity is indeterminate.

Epistemicists like Timothy Williamson (cf. 1994) deny that we should render it implausible that there is such a sharp borderline merely because we are necessarily ignorant of its existence. Vagueness, according to epistemicism, consists precisely in our necessary ignorance of such sharp boundaries. The other problem is that even if personal identity is indeterminate, the claim cannot by itself establish one criterion over others: in order to do so, it would have to exclude those thought experiments that challenge opposing criteria while leaving untouched those that supposedly establish the preferred criterion. It is doubtful, however, that the indeterminacy of personal identity can be exploited selectively, for physiological and psychological continuity relations are equally indeterminate in a particular range of cases (cf. Parfit 1984). Furthermore, in those cases in which they are not, for example Body Swap, Human Vegetable, and Fetus, appeal to indeterminacy does little to remove the contradictory intuitions that these cases trigger. Consequently, unless one holds that personal identity is categorically indeterminate whenever the physiological and psychological features of a human being come apart, appeal to indeterminacy cannot establish the rejection of the Big Assumption in such a way as to avoid the Paradox’s conclusion.

(c) The most common strategy is to bite the bullet and some or other allegedly absurd conclusion of the thought experiments. The defender of the Psychological Criterion must hold that we are not identical with a past fetus or infant, and that we will not have survived if fallen into a persistent vegetative state. Defenders of a Physiological Criterion, on the other hand, must commit to the consequence that if X’s head is grafted onto Y’s body, then the resulting person is Y and not X, even though this person shares all psychological features with X before the operation.

The problem with this strategy is that, if accepted, we seem to be unable to decide on a criterion of personal identity on the basis of intuitions at all, on pain of unjustifiably favoring one’s own over other people’s intuitions. On the assumption that we are unable to hierarchically structure these conflicting intuitions, we have a classical stand-off: there are two sides to the coin of personal identity and appeal to intuition plainly underdetermines preferring one side over the other. The problem is that human beings are organic material objects, the persistence of which is determined by these objects’ following a continuous trajectory between space-time points. The further question of whether or not human beings are essentially organic material objects depends on the question of whether psychological properties render human beings to be sufficiently dissimilar from such objects so as to “deserve” their own identity criterion. The fear underlying the Paradox of Personal Identity, then, is that there may be no metaphysical fact to the matter as to whether the antecedently specifiable differences between human beings and other organic or inorganic material objects count as sufficient in order for us to have persistence conditions different from these objects. It does not seem as if any possible thought experiment, irrespectively of how unequivocal our intuitions about it, could redeem this fear. Personal identity theorists, therefore, ought to offer a more comprehensive account of the ontological status of persons and their relation to the constituents that make them up.

4. Parfit and the Unimportance of Personal Identity

Derek Parfit proposes a theory of the ontological status of persons, which promises to answer the problem of fission and the paradox of personal identity. While this article cannot do justice to the complexities of Parfit’s theory, which has been the focal point of debate since 1970, it is worth mentioning its main features.

Although Parfit affirms the existence of persons, their special ontological status as non-separately-existing substances can be expressed by the claim that persons do not have to be listed separately on an inventory of what exists. In particular, persons themselves are distinct from their bodies and psychologies, but the existence of a person consists in nothing over and above the existence of a brain and body and the occurrence of an interrelated series of mental and physical events. These are the foundational claims of Parfit’s constitutive reductionism. Consider an analogy: Cellini’s Venus is made of bronze. Although the lump of bronze and the statue itself surely exist, these objects have different persistence conditions: if melted down, Venus ceases to exist while the lump of bronze does not. Therefore, they are not identical; rather, so the suggestion, the lump of bronze constitutes the statue. The same is true of persons, who are constituted by, but not identical with, a physiology, a psychology, and the occurrence of an interrelated series of causal and cognitive relations.

Now, how does this relate to the fission case? We must first note that Parfit believes (i) that our persistence consists in physical and/or psychological continuity; (ii) that personal identity is indeterminate in some cases, that is, that sometimes there is no right-or-wrong answer to the question of whether somebody has ceased to exist in the course of a certain adventure (see 3.b.); (iii) that what prudentially matters in survival is psychological continuity; (iv) that personal identity relations must respect the remaining formal properties of identity. This means that in the fission case Y₁ and Y₂ cannot be identical with X because the transitivity of identity is violated: therefore, X dies in the fission case. It further means, however, that X has two Parfitian survivors, Y₁ and Y₂, which is, according to Parfit, as good (or even better) than being identical with Y₁ and/or Y₂. This is the upshot of Parfit’s claim that what prudentially matters is psychological continuity: for all we should care, from a purely rational point of view, it is good enough for us to be psychologically continuous with one or more future persons and consequently it would be irrational for us to prefer our own continued existence to death by fission. Generally, according to Parfit, psychological continuity with any reliable cause matters in survival, and since personal identity does not consist merely in psychological continuity with any reliable cause, personal identity is not what matters in survival.

5. References and Further Reading

ANTHOLOGIES

• Bermúdez, Jos‚ Luis; Marcel, Anthony & Eilan, Naomi eds. (1995), The Body and the Self (Cambridge, MA & London: The MIT Press)
• Blakemore, Colin & Greenfield, Susan eds. (1987), Mindwaves (Oxford: Blackwell)
• Charles, David & Lennon, Kathleen eds. (1992), Reduction, Explanation, and Realism (Oxford: Clarendon)
• Cockburn, David ed. (1991), Human Beings, Royal Institute of Philosophy Supplement, Vol. 29 (Cambridge University Press)
• Dancy, Jonathan ed. (1997), Reading Parfit (Oxford: Blackwell)
• Davies, Martin & Stone, Tony eds. (1995), Folk Psychology: The Theory of Mind Debate (Oxford: Blackwell)
• Harris, Henry ed. (1995), Identity (Oxford: Clarendon)
• Lovibond, Sabina & Williams, Stephen G. eds. (1996), Essays for David Wiggins: Identity, Truth, and Value (Oxford: Blackwell)
• Macdonald, Graham F. ed. (1979), Perception and Identity: Essays Presented to A. J. Ayer, with His Replies (Ithaca, New York: Cornell University Press)
• Martin, Raymond & Barresi, John eds. (2003), Personal Identity (Oxford: Blackwell)
• Perry, John ed. (1975), Personal Identity (Berkeley & Los Angeles, CA: University of California Press)
• Rorty, Amelie O. ed. (1976), The Identities of Persons (Berkeley & Los Angeles, CA: University of California Press)

BOOKS AND ARTICLES

• Ayers, Michael (1991), Locke: Epistemology and Ontology, 2 vols. (London & New York: Routledge)
• Baker, Lynne Rudder (1997), “Why Constitution Is Not Identity,” The Journal of Philosophy, Vol. 94, No. 12, 599-621
• Baillie, James (1993), “Recent Work on Personal Identity,” Philosophical Books, Vol. 34, No. 4, 193-206
• Behrendt, Kathy (2003), “The New Neo-Kantian and Reductionist Debate,” Pacific Philosophical Quarterly Vol. 84, No. 4, 331-50
• Blackburn, Simon W. (1984), “Has Kant Refuted Parfit?,” in Dancy ed. (1997), pp. 180-201
• Butler, Joseph (1736), “Of Personal Identity,” First Dissertation to The Analogy of Religion (reprinted in Perry ed. (1975), pp. 99-105)
• Campbell, John (1992), “The First Person: The Reductionist View of the Self,” in Charles & Lennon eds. (1992), pp. 381-419
• Cassam, Quassim (1989), “Kant and Reductionism,” Review of Metaphysics, Vol. 43, No. 1, 72-106
• Cassam, Quassim (1992), “Reductionism and First-Person Thinking,” in Charles & Lennon eds. (1992), pp. 361-80
• Cassam, Quassim (1993), “Parfit on Persons,” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, Vol. 93, 17-37
• Cassam, Quassim (1997), Self and World (Oxford University Press)
• Chisholm, Roderick M. (1976), Person and Object (Chicago & La Salle, IL: Open Court)
• Crane, Tim (2001), Elements of Mind (Oxford University Press)
• Doepke, Frederick C. (1996), The Kinds of Things: A Theory of Personal Identity Based on Transcendental Argument (Chicago & La Salle, IL: Open Court)
• Evans, Gareth M. (1982), The Varieties of Reference, ed. John McDowell (New York: Oxford University Press)
• Evans, Gareth M. (1985), Collected Papers, ed. Antonia Phillips (Oxford: Clarendon)
• Garrett, Brian (1991), “Personal Identity and Reductionism,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, Vol. 51, No. 2, 361-73
• Garrett, Brian (1995), “Wittgenstein and the First Person,” Australasian Journal of Philosophy, Vol. 73, No. 3, 347-55
• Garrett, Brian (1998), Personal Identity and Self-Consciousness (London: Routledge)
• Geach, Peter (1967), “Identity,” Review of Metaphysics, Vol. 21, No.1 (reprinted in his (1972), Logic Matters (Oxford: Blackwell), pp. 238-47)
• Gordon, Robert M. (1995), “Folk Psychology as Simulation,” in Davies & Stone eds. (1995), pp. 59-73
• Heal, Jane (1995), “Replication and Functionalism,” in Davies & Stone eds. (1995), pp. 45-59
• Hirsch, Eli (1991), “Divided Minds,” The Philosophical Review, Vol. 100, No. 1, 3-30
• Hume, David (1739), A Treatise on Human Nature, ed. Norton, David F. & Norton, Mary J. (Oxford University Press)
• Johnston, Mark (1992), “Constitution Is Not Identity,” Mind, Vol. 101, No. 401, 89-105
• Johnston, Mark (1997), “Human Concerns Without Superlative Selves,” in Dancy ed. (1997), pp. 149-79
• Locke, John (1689), An Essay Concerning Human Understanding, ed. Woolhouse, Roger (London: Penguin, 1997)
• Lowe, E. Jonathan (1991), “Real Selves: Persons as Substantial Kinds,” in Cockburn ed. (1991), pp. 87-108
• Lowe, E. Jonathan (1996), Subjects of Experience (Cambridge University Press)
• Martin, Raymond (1998), Self-Concern: An Experiential Approach to What Matters in Survival (Cambridge University Press)
• McDowell, John (1997), “Reductionism and the First Person,” in Dancy ed. (1997), pp. 230-50
• Merricks, Trenton (1998), “There Are No Criteria of Identity Over Time,” No–s, Vol. 32, No.1, 106-124
• Moore, Adrian W. (1997), Points of View (Oxford: Clarendon)
• Nagel, Thomas (1971), “Brain Bisection and the Unity of Consciousness,” Synthese, Vol. 22, 396-413
• Nagel, Thomas (1986), The View From Nowhere (Oxford: Clarendon)
• Noonan, Harold W. (1989), Personal Identity (London: Routledge)
• Noonan, Harold (1993), “Constitution Is Identity,” Mind, Vol. 102, No. 405, 133-46
• Nozick, Robert (1981), Philosophical Explanations (Oxford: Clarendon)
• Olson, Eric T. (1997a), The Human Animal: Personal Identity Without Psychology (Oxford University Press)
• Olson, Eric T. (1997b), “Relativism and Persistence,” Philosophical Studies, Vol. 88, No. 2, 141-62
• Parfit, Derek A. (1971a), “Personal Identity,” The Philosophical Review, Vol. 80, No. 1, 3-27
• Parfit, Derek A. (1971b), On “The Importance of Self-Identity”,” The Journal of Philosophy, Vol. 68, No. 20, 683-90
• Parfit, Derek A. (1976), “Lewis, Perry, and What Matters,” in Rorty ed. (1976), pp. 91-107
• Parfit, Derek A. (1982), “Personal Identity and Rationality,” Synthese, Vol. 53, 227-41
• Parfit, Derek A. (1984), Reasons and Persons (Oxford University Press; revised reprint, Oxford: Clarendon, 1987)
• Parfit, Derek A. (1986), “Comments,” Ethics, Vol. 96, No. 4, 832-872
• Parfit, Derek A. (1987), “Divided Minds and the Nature of Persons,” in Blakemore & Greenfield eds. (1987), pp. 19-26
• Parfit, Derek A. (1995), “The Unimportance of Identity,” in Harris ed. (1995), pp. 13-45 (reprinted in Martin & Barresi eds. (2003), pp. 292-318)
• Parfit, Derek A. (1999), “Experiences, Subjects, and Conceptual Schemes,” Philosophical Topics, Vol. 26, Nos. 1-2, 217-70
• Peacocke, Christopher (1983), Sense and Content: Experience, Thought, and Their Relations (Oxford: Clarendon)
• Perry, John (1972), “Can the Self Divide?,” The Journal of Philosophy, Vol. 69, No. 16, 463-88
• Shoemaker, Sydney (1963), Self-Knowledge and Self-Identity (Ithaca, New York: Cornell University Press)
• Shoemaker, Sydney (1970), “Persons and Their Past,” American Philosophical Quarterly, Vol. 7, No. 4, 269-85 (reprinted in Shoemaker (1984), pp. 19-48)
• Shoemaker, Sydney (1984), Identity, Cause, and Mind (Cambridge University Press; expanded edition, Oxford University Press, 2003)
• Shoemaker, Sydney (1985), “Critical Notice of Reasons and Persons,” Mind, Vol. 94, No. 375, 443-53
• Shoemaker, Sydney (1997), “Parfit on Identity,” in Dancy ed. (1997), pp. 135-48 (revised version of his 1985)
• Shoemaker, Sydney (1999), “Self, Body, and Coincidence,” Aristotelian Society Supplementary Volume 73, 287-306
• Shoemaker, Sidney & Swinburne, Richard (1984), Personal Identity (Oxford: Blackwell)
• Snowdon, Paul F. (1991), “Personal Identity and Brain Transplants,” in Cockburn ed. (1991), pp. 109-26
• Snowdon, Paul F (1995), “Persons, Animals, and Bodies,” in Bermúdez, Marcel & Eilan eds. (1995), pp. 71-86
• Snowdon, Paul F (1996), “Persons and Personal Identity,” in Lovibond & Williams (1996), pp. 33-48
• Strawson, Peter F. (1959), Individuals: An Essay in Descriptive Metaphysic (London & New York: Methuen)
• Strawson, Galen (1999), “Self, Body, and Experience,” Aristotelian Society Supplementary Volume 73, 307-32
• Swinburne, Richard G. (1973-4), “Personal Identity,” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, Vol. 74, 231-47
• Thompson, Judith J. (1997), “People and Their Bodies,” in Dancy ed. (1997), pp. 202-29
• Unger, Peter (1979), “I Do Not Exist,” in Macdonald ed. (1979), pp. 235-51
• Van Inwagen, Peter (1990), Material Beings (Ithaca, New York: Cornell University Press)
• Wiggins, David R. P. (2001), Sameness and Substance Renewed (Oxford University Press)
• Wilkes, Kathleen V. (1988), Real People: Personal Identity Without Thought Experiments (Oxford: Clarendon)
• Williams, Bernard A. O. (1956-7), “Personal Identity and Individuation,” Proceedings to the Aristotelian Society, Vol. 57, 229-52 (my references are to reprint in Williams (1973), pp. 1-18)
• Williams, Bernard A. O. (1970), “The Self and the Future,” Philosophical Review, Vol. 79, No. 2, 161-80 (reprinted in Williams (1973), pp. 46-63)
• Williams, Bernard A. O. (1973), Problems of the Self: Philosophical Papers 1956-1972 (Cambridge University Press)
• Williams, Bernard A. O. (1978), Descartes: The Project of Pure Enquiry (Hardmondsworth: Penguin Books)
• Williamson, Timothy (1994), Vagueness (London & New York: Routledge)
• Wittgenstein, Ludwig (1922), Tractatus Logico-Philosophicus, transl. D.F. Pears & B.F. McGuiness (London: Routledge and Kegan Paul, 1961)
• Wittgenstein, Ludwig (1953), Philosophical Investigations, transl. G.E.M. Anscombe (Oxford: Blackwell)
• Wright, Crispin (1983), Frege’s Conception of Numbers as Objects (Aberdeen University Press)
• Zimmerman, Dean W. (1998), “Criteria of Identity and the “Identity Mystics”,” Erkenntnis, Vol. 48, Nos. 2-3, 281-301

Author Information

Carsten Korfmacher
Email: C.Korfmacher.99 (at) cantab.net
Linacre College, Oxford University
United Kingdom

Supervenience and Determination

The term “supervenience” gained prominence in the twentieth century when it was suggested that moral properties supervene on natural properties and that our mental characteristics supervene on our physical characteristics such as the properties of our nervous system. The term can be defined as follows. For two sets of properties, A (the supervenient set) and B (the subvenient set or supervenience base), A supervenes on B just in case there can be no difference in A without a difference in B. Turning this principle on its head gives us the converse concept of determination: B determines A just in case sameness with respect to B implies sameness with respect to A. Supervenience and determination are simply two sides of the same coin.

From the basic definition initially presented, supervenience might seem a fairly innocuous principle, yet it has led a somewhat murky and controversial existence: some love it; some hate it. It was, for example, described by John Post as an “accordion word: indefinitely stretchable” (1984, p. 163). It has certainly been pulled about throughout its history, but it does have its limits. Indeed, others view it as too limited to be of any philosophical worth whatsoever. This article charts the history of the concept of supervenience, discusses the current panoply of definitions, and reviews some of the more tractable portions of the contemporary debate. The primary aim is to gain a feel for the basic concept without getting bogged down with the more formal and abstruse aspects of supervenience. The aim of this first section is to get to grips with the core idea of supervenience, and see some of the contexts in which it has been and might be used.

Table of Contents

1. Getting to Grips with Supervenience
2. The Recent History of Supervenience
3. The Unlovely Proliferation of Formulations
4. Supervenience and Causation
5. Reduction, Emergence, and Multiple Realization
6. Adding Mystery to Mystery?
7. References and Further Reading

1. Getting to Grips with Supervenience

As David Lewis puts it, “We have supervenience when there could be no difference of one sort without differences of another sort” (1986, p. 14). For example: no difference in an individual’s mental characteristics without some difference in physical characteristics; no difference in a computer’s program without a difference in the computer’s circuitry; no difference in the economy without some difference in the behavior of its underlying economic agents; no difference in the temperature of a gas without some difference in the behavior of the molecules forming it, and so on. But notice that there can be differences in the neurons, circuitry, agents, and molecules without a difference in mental, computational, economic, and thermal properties.

The idea in each of the above cases is that some property A (or family of properties) is “determined” by some other properties B that do not themselves possess the property A, and that do not reduce to B (though this is a controversial point, as we shall see): individual neurons don’t possess mental characteristics; circuits don’t possess computational properties; individual agents don’t possess economic properties; and individual molecules don’t have temperatures. The intent is to avoid the stronger relations (such as identity or definability) between the types of property, generally because it often isn’t clear how there could be such strong relations holding them together. Part of the reason for this, and one prime motivation for supervenience, is that mental, computational, economic, and thermodynamic characteristics are “multiply realizable:: the same properties might be realized by very different underlying physical configurations or stuff. However, it needs to be strong enough to support a kind of non-symmetric dependence between two levels of property, such that a “lower” level determines a “higher” level. This feature may give rise to the notion of “levels of dependence” and, in certain cases, “hierarchical organization”: the mental is at a higher “level,” is higher up the hierarchy, from the physical; the economy is at a higher level than the economic agents, and so on.

This hierarchy of levels charts out a progression of ontological dependence too: without the physical stuff of neurons, circuits, people, and molecules (or something like them), the higher level states would not exist at all. This feature thus makes supervenience a useful tool in analyzing relations between the subject matter of distinct theoretical disciplines, such as the relation between physics and biology. It is, more generally useful in analyzing relations between things that are connected (correlated) in a way that doesn’t suggest reduction or identity. However, note that levels are not a generic feature of supervenience. Consider the case of the relationship between the length of the sides of a square and the area of the square. There is, in both directions, no difference in one without a difference in the other, and once the sides (respectively, area) are fixed the area (respectively, length) is fixed. So we have a clear case of supervenience. But this is a symmetric case, and so the notion of a level of dependence or hierarchy makes no sense; it only makes sense when the relation is asymmetric, and these make for the most philosophically interesting cases.

But, before we get bogged down with such details, what is the basic idea of supervenience? It is perhaps best understood by means of a colorful example. To this end, let us begin by adapting a simple story presented by Paul Teller (1983). Teller asks us to imagine a bunch of watches churned out of an assembly line in the same state, so that they are functionally and qualitatively (at least, in terms of their intrinsic properties) identical—clearly the watches will register the same time. The properties having to do with the physical makeup of the watches—their structure and composition, and so on—give us our B set of properties (the subvenient set). The supervenient A set has to do with the time-keeping properties of the watches—for example, whether they enable their owners to get into work on time, and so on. In this case, as Teller points out, the A properties of some particular watch will be the same as any other watch from the assembly line since they have the same physical makeup (B properties), and that is all that counts towards the A properties in this story. Being a good timekeeper supervenes on the physical makeup of the timekeeping device: one could not alter the time-keeping properties of the watches without altering their underlying structural and compositional properties. Moreover, any two devices that share their physical makeup will either both be good or both be bad timekeepers. That is to say, the physical make-up of a watch determines its time-keeping properties.

Though this captures much of the basic idea as encapsulated in our opening definition (which we can abbreviate to “no A-difference without a B-difference”), it misses one very crucial detail: modal impact. Supervenience is not intended to be a contingent “matter of actual fact” claim concerning two sets of properties that happen to be correlated at some particular time or place. Rather, it is intended to cover any situation involving A and B, covering any time, place, and world—though there will be natural restrictions concerning which worlds are to be included here (for example, logically possible [so that all logically coherent, non-contradictory worlds are considered], nomologically possible [so that all worlds permitted by the laws of physics are considered], and metaphysically possible [considering a class of worlds somewhere between the logically possible and the nomologically possible ones]). Different restrictions give different strengths. In our example, we should have to extend our story to include all possible watches that are indistinguishable in terms of their B-properties, including those inhabiting distinct worlds (from alien worlds and Twin-Earths, perhaps to worlds with different laws of physics). This additional modal aspect results in a profusion of distinct formulations that aim to adequately capture the fundamental notion of supervenience. Further proliferation results from the question of what are to be the objects that have the properties that enter into the supervenience/determination relation. Supervenience is, then, clearly far from innocuous!

2. The Recent History of Supervenience

Jaegwon Kim (1993, p. 131) notes that the term “supervenience” was in currency as far back as 1594. In its vernacular sense it means to “[come upon] a given event as something additional and extraneous (perhaps as something unexpected)” (ibid, p.132). However, the concept of Supervenience, as a philosophical term of art, is generally acknowledged to be traceable to G.E. Moore’s work on value theory, and from thence to R.M. Hare’s work on meta-ethics in which the term ‘supervenience’ was introduced into the philosophical literature. There it stifled for some time, before being unearthed by Davidson who applied it to the ‘mental-physical’ relationship. Let us review some central points from this historical development.

In “The Conception of Intrinsic Value” Moore writes that:

…if a given thing possesses any kind of intrinsic value in a certain degree, then not only must that same thing possess it, under all circumstances, in the same degree, but also anything exactly like it, must, under all circumstances, possess it in exactly the same degree. … it is not possible that of two exactly similar things one should possess it and the other not, or that one should possess it in one degree, and the other in a different one.

(Moore 1922, p. 261)

This sentiment is virtually parroted by Hare, this time specifically utilizing the term “supervenience” to describe the relation between certain natural (non-moral, physical) and moral properties, giving us ‘moral supervenience’:

…let us take that characteristic of “good” which has been called its supervenience. Suppose that we say ‘St. Francis was a good man.’ It is logically impossible to say this and to maintain at the same time that there might have been another man placed exactly in the same circumstances as St. Francis, and who behaved in exactly the same way, but who differed from St. Francis in this respect only, that he was not a good man.

(Hare 1952, p. 145)

Before we continue with the historical matters, let us briefly pause to consider what this means. Again, let’s give a simple example. Imagine we draw up a pair of catalogues of the properties of two people Saint Francis and Faint Srancis. The properties of Saint Francis are, say, kindness, bravery, niceness, neighborliness, and goodness. Faint Srancis’ properties differ from Saint Francis only in that the last property, goodness, is missing from his catalogue. Suppose, instead, that he has the property “badness” in its place. Now, according to the moral supervenience thesis espoused by Hare, this is simply not a genuinely possible state of affairs. All of the other properties, minus goodness, serve to fix or determine the property of goodness. It is just not possible that there be two such individuals differing in this way (whether they occupy the same world or not). Therefore, in possessing all of Saint Francis’ properties up to, but not including goodness, Faint Srancis must also thereby possess the property of goodness too. This is what is meant in saying that the property of goodness supervenes on a family of natural properties not including goodness. (Note that this matches Stalnaker’s, 1996, p. 87, preferred definition of supervenience: “To say that the A-properties or facts are supervenient on the B-properties or facts is to say that the A-facts are, in a sense, redundant, since they are already implicitly specified when one has specified all the B-facts.”) Let us now return to the historical path of the concept.

As Kim and others have pointed out, it seems that both some version of the concept and the term ‘supervenience’ were in operation before Moore’s and Hare’s usage in the context of the British Emergentist School. The emergentist’s understanding of supervenience, being more in line with the vernacular sense, does not match the current understanding as well as Moore’s and Hare’s. See McLaughlin 1992 for an excellent analysis. Indeed, supervenience, as a concept, most likely has much earlier roots than this, and one can readily find examples (or approximations, at least) littered throughout the history of philosophy. Leibniz’s theory of space and time might be one such example, with spatial and temporal properties supervenient on non-spatial and non-temporal events. Hume’s theory of causation might be another example, with cause and effect supervening on sequences of events that do not have causal properties. However, for the purposes of a cleaner exposition we will stick with the orthodox historical trajectory of supervenience. Not many philosophers initially picked up on Hare’s use of supervenience, but new life was breathed into it when Donald Davidson (1970) utilized it to provide some of the support for his anomalous monism. For example, in an oft-quoted passage he writes:

Although the position I describe denies there are psychophysical laws, it is consistent with the view that mental characteristics are in some sense dependent, or supervenient, on physical characteristics. Such supervenience might be taken to mean that there cannot be two events alike in all physical respects but differing in some mental respect, or that an object cannot alter in some mental respect without altering in some physical respect.

(Davidson 1970, p.214)

Davidson uses this supervenience relation to defend a non-reductive, but nonetheless non-dualist, position with regard to the way in which the mental stands to the physical (that is, psychophysical supervenience). Though the mental is certainly dependent upon the physical, in the sense that the physical determines the mental, it cannot be reduced to it since there are no psychophysical laws while there are, of course, physical laws:

[P]sychological characteristics cannot be reduced to the others, nevertheless they may be (and I think are) strongly dependent on them. Indeed, there is a sense in which the physical characteristics of an event (or object or state) determine the psychological characteristics…

(Davidson 1973, p. 716)

Once it entered the mainstream literature via Davidson, other philosophers (Jaegwon Kim in particular) began to focus on supervenience as an object of study in its own right—the 1984 Spindel conference saw the beginnings of much of this new direction (see Horgan (ed.), 1984—required reading for those wishing to gain a deeper appreciation of the foundations of supervenience). This trend shows no signs of letting up, though there is certainly some increased negativity about the concept’s usefulness and significance. A large part of the perceived problem with supervenience is that there is no unique, agreed-upon formulation of it. Instead there are many distinct formulations. However, this might not be such a bad thing; different jobs may require different tools. It is entirely possible that the fortunes of supervenience will reverse with the coming of age of the so-called “science of complexity,” for this involves direct consideration of the relationship between levels in hierarchies whereby a higher level is generated by the level below—it also involves many of the “special sciences.” Supervenience might thus provide the required conceptual framework to make sense of this feature of complex systems. It has, for example, been endorsed by Elliot Sober (1993) as the best way of understanding the biological concept of “fitness,” the idea being that fitness is something exhibited by very different species and individuals in relation to very different environments.

3. The Unlovely Proliferation of Formulations

We come now to the “embarrassment of riches” issue concerning the formulation of supervenience—the problem of there appearing to be too many possible formulations. David Lewis refers to this as an “unlovely proliferation” (1986, p.14). The proliferation arises simply in trying to pin down what is meant by supervenience in a precise way. The core idea that a formulation needs to capture is that fixing some one set of properties fixes some other property (or properties). The first distinction we meet is that between weak and strong supervenience. These can be stated simply enough in plain English as follows:

[Weak-SV]: For any possible world w, B-duplicates in w are A-duplicates in w.

[Strong-SV]: For any possible worlds w and w*, B-duplicates (x and y) in w and w* respectively are A-duplicates in w and w* respectively.

So, for example, according to Weak-SV, if we (perhaps here on our ‘plain vanilla’ Earth) managed to create a Star-Trek style replication machine and proceeded to replicate the physical makeup of a person P, generating a copy P_rep, then P and P_rep would share their mental characteristics too: “same worldly” physical duplicates are also mental duplicates. To understand Strong-SV we simply imagine that some Twin-Earthlings (in another possible world) got hold of an exact blueprint of P and are sufficiently advanced to be able to create a physical replica. Once again P and P_rep are mental duplicates since they are physical duplicates. (By simply setting w = w*, and assuming the same types of worlds, we see that Strong-SV implies Weak-SV, but not vice versa.)

The difference between Weak and Strong supervenience, then, simply boils down to their respective modal strengths. One world is quantified over in the former, with objects compared within a world, while all worlds (subject to some restriction) are quantified over in the latter, with objects compared across worlds. For this reason Jackson (1998, p. 9) refers to these types as “intra-world” and “inter-world” supervenience respectively. Clearly the weak formulation cannot support basic counterfactuals of the form “if there were some B-duplicate of some object, then it would be an A-duplicate too.” Without this ability, Weak-SV is pretty much useless, for some dependency might be purely accidental. For example, it is perfectly consistent with Weak-SV that there be a world physically identical to ours yet with no conscious beings. (Though, of course, if one wants to describe such possibly accidental relations then Weak-SV might indeed be the right tool for the job.) Note also that Weak-SV does not tell us that a certain group of B-properties makes one morally good, or a piece beautiful, or a piece of matter alive. All Weak-SV tells us is that B-twins are A-twins; it does not tell us whether B-twins are one way or the other morally speaking, for example, just that whatever goes for on goes for the other. Hence, it fails to accomplish the task we set it: namely, to encode a notion of dependence and determination. Strong-SV gets around this problem of course, but it has its own problems. Suppose that there are two individuals, Fred and Ted, inhabiting worlds w and w* respectively. Let Fred and Ted be “almost” B-duplicates, differing only in one single trivial B-property, suppose one is wearing aftershave and the other is not. Then it follows from Strong-SV that Fred could be conscious but Ted not, all because he didn’t remember to put aftershave on!

There are alternative “modal operator” [MO] versions of the weak and strong formulations of supervenience. Again in “plain” English, these are:

[MO-Weak-SV]: Necessarily, if anything has property F in A, then there is some property G in B such that the thing has G, and whatever has G has F.

[MO-Strong-SV]: Necessarily, if anything has property F in A, then there is some property G in B such that the thing has G, and necessarily whatever has G has F.

The only difference between strong and weak here is that the strong formulation features an additional necessity operator. What these definitions amount to is this: Weak supervenience holds at any world (given restrictions on the class of worlds), and once that world is selected one compares B-duplicates, in that world, and sees whether they are A-duplicates, if weak supervenience is true then they will be. Strong supervenience holds at any world (again, given restrictions on the allowable worlds), and once a world is selected it follows that at any world accessible from that world, objects in the initially selected and the accessed world that are B-duplicates, will be A-duplicates—hence, one can compare cross-world cases. The modal operator versions capture something that the possible worlds formulations miss, namely that possession of a supervenient property demands that a subvenient one be had as well. So, in the possible worlds formulation, two things can be B-duplicates by not possessing any B-properties (that is, if they exactly zero B-properties)! Not so in the modal operator versions.

Another distinction concerns that between Weak-SV and Strong-SV, taken as a pair, and Global supervenience, which we can write as:

[Global-SV]: Possible worlds w and w* that are B-duplicates are also A-duplicates.

Thus, whereas Weak-SV and Strong-SV concern the properties of individual objects (within a world and potentially across worlds respectively), Global-SV concerns whole possible worlds and the pattern of properties distributed over them. One might wish for such a formulation to capture certain philosophical theses, such as physicalism (roughly: fixing the physical facts fixes everything), Humean supervenience (roughly: everything is fixed by the spatiotemporal distribution of local intrinsic properties), or determinism (roughly: everything to the future is fixed by the present, and perhaps past, facts), which involve worlds (or ‘world segments’) taken as individual objects. In each formulation, though, we can distinguish between cases with differing modal force by quantifying over different types of possible world (that is, by imposing different accessibility relations on the set of worlds). An accessibility relation is just a binary relation R_Mod (w, w*) holding between pairs of worlds, w and w*, so that R_Mod (w, w*) is true whenever w* satisfies the same M-laws (of physics, logic, and so forth) as w. If you’re only bothered about relations satisfying our laws of physics, then you will only want to consider the nomologically possible worlds, in which case R_Nom (w, w*) whenever w* follows the same physical laws as w. If you want to go beyond our laws, then quantification over the metaphysically possible worlds is more appropriate (one needs to ‘expand’ the accessibility relation).

There is some confusion in spelling out what is meant in saying that worlds are B-duplicates. Does it mean that the worlds may differ in other ways, so long as they do not differ with respect to B-properties? For example, might we consider two worlds B-duplicates where one world, but not the other, has ghosts (with C-properties)? If they are B-duplicates, and B-properties account for all there is, and the worlds contain the same individuals, then what distinguishes such worlds? These issues can cause problems when one tries to put supervenience to work. Moreover, Global-SV faces a similar problem to that mentioned with regard to Strong-SV. So long as two worlds are not B-duplicates they can differ in any way you like with respect to their A-properties. For example, if one single atom is out of place, then this could mean that one world has conscious beings and the other world only has zombies!

A further distinction is to be made between “single domain supervenience” and “multiple domain supervenience.” The difference here concerns whether we wish to consider the A- and B-properties associated to the same or to different things respectively. In the latter, multiple domain case, one would look at those cases where there cannot be A-differences in one thing without a B-difference in some other distinct thing. Thus, weak and strong are clearly single domain formulations. The multiple domain account has several applications: for example, in the case of the problem of material composition (for example, the way a statue stands to the lump of clay that out of which it is composed), those who believe that the statue and the clay literally coincide (share their spatial boundaries at a time, if not for all time, and indeed these divergent histories is what makes them different—they can also differ in their modal properties, so that they satisfy different counterfactuals) will want to say that the statue supervenes on the clay. But since these are two different things, according to the coincidence advocate, w will need a multiple domain account. For the same reasons, those who view societies, or other similar structures, as separate objects, autonomous from the individuals from which they are composed, will need a multiple domain account if they wish to say that social properties supervene on the properties of the underlying individuals. (One can also formulate “local” or “regional” supervenience, which restrict the supervenience relation to a spacetime region within a world, rather than some concrete object within a world. Again, this splits into weak and strong versions.)

There is something of a cottage industry devoted to spelling out the various entailment relations between the various formulations. We saw that Strong-SV implies Weak-SV, and it looks like Strong-SV implies Global-SV too. However, the converse is trickier: given a certain understanding of the properties involved, they become equivalent. However, equivalence is ruled out by a simple counterexample (due to Petrie): Suppose we have two worlds w and w*, each with two properties A = {S}| and B= {P}, and two individuals x and y (and no more) in world w, and x* and y* (and no more) in world w*. The world w is characterized by the following distribution of properties over its individuals: Px, Sx, Py, ~Sy. While world w* is characterized by the distribution: Px*, ~Sx*, ~Py*, and ~Sy*. Clearly, strong supervenience is ruled out by this model since x and x* are B-duplicates but not A-duplicates. But this isn’t incompatible with global supervenience because the worlds are not B-duplicates, so A-duplication is irrelevant. The fact that this model is consistent with global supervenience yet inconsistent with strong supervenience is enough, says Petrie, to show that they are not equivalent. There are objections to this argument, but we shan’t go in to these matters here. Let us instead turn to some controversial issues that arise in contemporary debates.

4. Supervenience and Causation

Supervenient properties are often those to which we wish to attach causal powers. For example, mental effects from mental causes and even physical effects from mental causes. If one thinks of an old love it may cause one to feel sad, or have some other emotion. It may cause one to cry. But the mental supervenes on the physical, which means that the physical fixes the mental. So both mental causes and mental effects are supervenient on some physical conditions. But then the mental cause is irrelevant here since the physical conditions are sufficient to bring about the effect. At best, the mental effect is over-determined by the mental and physical causes. At worst, it leads to epiphenomenalism about mental properties. Presumably the ground of the supervenience relation will be relevant here.

If the supervenient properties are understood as emergent, then it is possible that some “global” properties, to do with a whole system, can causally effect other things, and its parts (the supervenience base). For example, a group of agents can interact to generate an economy, but the economy has properties of its own (prices, interest rates, and such like); these will be able to influence how the agents behave. In other words, there is the possibility of a ‘feedback loop’ from global to local. Such a possibility would appear not to be available in the case of a “mereological” grounding of a supervenience relation, according to which the whole is just identified with the sum of its parts. In the former case, the whole is supposed to be some how more than the sum of its parts (due to the non-linear nature of the interactions between the parts). But, nonetheless, in both cases, once we fix the subvenient properties, we fix the supervenient ones too. However, there are very problematic causal issues involved in the case with a feedback loop where we would appear to have “downward causation” so that the supervenient properties constrain and even modify the subvenient ones. The existence of a “preferred direction” to the relation seems to have been lost in such cases. This is an interesting topic in need of much further work, but we cannot pursue it further here.

5. Reduction, Emergence, and Multiple Realization

Reductionism is as old as philosophy itself. The ancient Greek cosmologists each defended what appear to be reductive theories according to which everything that exists is made up of some single fundamental element or a group of such elements. Most apt here is the version of atomism given to us by Leuccipus and Democritus according to which all things, including secondary qualities, souls, and thoughts, were reduced to atoms moving in the void. But there are some things that, it seems, are not easily reducible. Take Beethoven’s Fifth Symphony. How does one reduce this? To a sound structure (that is, a sequence of sounds)? If so, then many different sound structures can realize it, on CDs, Vinyl, a badly tuned piano, and so on. This piece of music is, then, multiply realizable (there is a many-to-one relationship between the subvenient realizations and the supervenient property). We might also consider some “higher order” properties of musical works, say “being a grand piece of music.” This property too is multiply realizable: there are many ways to be a grand piece of music. This seems to rule out reduction, at least to a unique sound structure. But, and here we return to Hare’s example, if there are two indistinguishable realizations, then if one is a grand work of music, the other cannot fail to be. The grandeur is determined by the sound structure—we are, of course, assuming that grandeur is a property intrinsic to a work, otherwise one and the same sound structure could be both grand and not grand.

This multiple realizability lies at the core of supervenience’s job, namely, to describe a dependency weaker than identity and reduction. The idea is, that fixing the physical properties of the work of music (the tones, durations, intensities, and so on) suffices to fix any and all aesthetic properties the piece might have. But then the idea of emergence amounts to the claim that these aesthetic properties (and similar higher-level properties) are not reducible to the physical ones, they are something “novel” arising from the physical organization. (The distinction between physical and non-physical properties here amounts to both the fact that the latter type can be had by many objects with different natures and constitutions, and the fact that the former type obey the laws of, possibly complete, physics. However, nothing said here hinges on this distinction, one might as well say that aesthetic properties are physical too, since they occupy the world. Thus, this is just a way of speaking to label a curious fact, namely that some properties seem not to be reducible to what are standardly taken to be unproblematic ‘physical’ properties, such as mass, charge, spin, and so on.) Dualism and epiphenomenalism are avoided (1) because the physical facts are needed to fix the emergent facts and (2) because the emergent properties are supposed to be causally efficacious: the beauty of the Adagio from Mahler’s Fifth Symphony can cause a person to cry; it isn’t the durations, intensities, and pitch of sounds that is causally responsible—though one might conceivably take a hard line here and argue that it is precisely the physical (subvenient) properties that cause the tears. (Though it must be understood that causation is far from simple in these contexts, as we saw in the previous section.)

In an early and pioneering work on supervenience and determination, in the context of a defense and formulation of physicalism, Hellman and Thompson were concerned with separating out supervenience from reduction. Physicalism can be understood simply as follows: When God made the World, did he just have to fix the facts regarding the elementary particles and the forces (the B-properties) and all the rest (the A-properties: colors, qualia, aesthetic properties, moral properties, and so forth) followed from that, or did he have to then attach all the rest? A physicalist will answer Yes to the former question. Supervenience, or rather determination, is supposed to support the affirmative answer, for it says precisely that the B-properties determine the A-properties. Hellman and Thompson wanted to show that supervenience is neutral in respect of reduction between supervenient and subvenient levels of properties.

Why might we wish to defend the view that supervenience is non-reductive? One reason, as we have seen, is to capture a notion of ontological dependence—say of the mind on physical brain states or processes—without eliminating the mind, or identifying the mind with the brain states. The problem with such a view is that prima facie it appears to let in ‘unphysical’ properties, that either amount to dualism or epiphenomenalism. There is certainly a problem in making ontological sense of supervenient properties, but one needn’t espouse either dualism or epiphenomenalism if one is committed to a supervenience thesis. For all that is being said is that fixing some one set of facts fixes some others. However, there is an argument that attempts to demonstrate that supervenience is reductive. Let us consider this argument, and then present one against reduction.

The argument is given in Kim’s “Supervenience and Nomological Incommensurables”. In capsule form, it goes as follows: Suppose we have two sets of properties, P (for physical) and S (for special, as in special science). Let s be a property in S and let p_n be the list of properties contained in P. Define q_n to be the set of maximally conjunctive properties that can be built from p_n (where the maximally conjunctive condition means that for each p_i, either p_i or its negation is a conjunct of q_n). If S is supervenient on P then any pair of objects that share some q_i must both possess s or both lack s. Now, let D be the disjunction of all of those q_i such that if an object has qi then it has s too. However, this implies that possession of an S property is equivalent to possession of a P property. In other words, for all x’s, s has x if and only if D has x (in shorthand: x , s(x) iff D(x)). This, of course, is tantamount to a reduction of S to P, for the claim is that every higher level, supervenient, property is coextensive with some Boolean complex of lower level, subvenient, properties, say a long (possibly infinite) disjunction of properties. Thus, any two objects with the supervenient property A must possess the very same subvenient property B, but B is a very complex property that will involve an exhaustive list of the ways that A could be had by any object.

Hellmann and Thompson’s strategy is to disallow infinite conjunctions and disjunctions of properties, thereby blocking the route to the infinitely complex properties that Kim’s argument let in, and therefore blocking the route to reduction. However, while an outright ban on such properties may be otherwise well motivated, it is too ad hoc in this case. A more promising approach to stop Kim’s argument is to simply not allow that the kind of Boolean operations that Kim utilizes to generate new properties result in genuine properties. One might apply this strategy either to negations of properties, disjunctive properties, conjunctive properties, or some combination of these (see McLaughlin’s article “Varieties of Supervenience”).

In his “Reduction of Mind” Lewis speaks of supervenience as a reductive principle, going somewhat against the philosophical grain. As a build up he writes:

I hold, as an a priori principle, that every contingent truth must be made true, somehow, by the pattern of coinstantiation of fundamental properties and relations [that is, occurring all together]. The whole truth about the world, including the mental part of the world, supervenes on this pattern. If two possible worlds were exactly isomorphic in their patterns of coinstantiation of fundamental properties and relations, they would thereby be exactly alike simpliciter.

(Lewis 1994, p.292)

Lewis adds to this that all the fundamental properties and relations are physical, so that a materialist thesis is generated from the supervenience—the position amounts, more or less, to a statement of his “Humean Supervenience;” the claim that “All there is to the world is a vast mosaic of local matters of fact…And that is all” (1986, p.ix-x) so that “truth supervenes on being” (1994b, p.225). But how can supervenience be reductive? Lewis gives the following example:

Imagine a grid of a million tiny spots – pixels – each of which can be made light or dark. When some are light and some are dark, they form a picture, replete with interesting gestalt properties. The case evokes reductionist comments. Yes, the picture really does exist. Yes, it really does have those gestalt properties. However, the picture and the properties reduce to the arrangement of light and dark pixels. They are nothing over and above the pixels. They make nothing true that is not made true already by the pixels. They could go unmentioned in an inventory of what there is without thereby rendering that inventory incomplete. And so on.

(Lewis 1994, p. 294)

Such comments Lewis happily endorses: “The picture reduces to the pixels. And that is because the picture supervenes on the pixels” (loc. cit.). Lewis’ position here stems from the fact that the supervenience relation is (in this case, at least) non-symmetric and relates large to small—though it isn’t at all obvious that this is sufficient for reduction.

However, there is a way for the anti-reductionist to respond here, and this response ties in to much of the contemporary debate regarding supervenience (and emergence). The response is known as the “multiple realizability” objection, and was first used by Jerry Fodor (1974) in the context of the debate concerning the non-reducibility of special science to lower-level science (ultimately, physics). The argument, in a nutshell, is that properties associated to a ‘special science’ (for example, psychology) can be realized by a multitude of heterogeneous lower-level properties or states. Let us see how this works by focusing on a simplified example given by Putnam (1975).

We are asked to consider a board that has a round hole in it of 5 inches in diameter, and a square peg that is 5 inches on each of its sides. Clearly the peg will not go into the hole. The question we are faced with is why the peg does not go through. Obviously, says Putnam, the respective size and shape of the peg and hole give us the answer. These properties, size and shape, Putnam refers to as “macroproperties”, as contrasted with the “microproperties,” of the peg and board, namely the positions, momenta, charge, and so forth, of the atoms composing them. Clearly the shape and size of the peg and the board supervene on the microproperties. Do these microproperties provide an answer to the above question? Putnam says not, because the details at that level are irrelevant to why the peg did not penetrate the board: the microproperties could have been very different, in fact, and the result would have been the same. What are we to conclude from this? That the “peg/board/hole”-level features (the macroproperties) are autonomous, so that they cannot be reduced to lower-level features (the microproperties). This is, more or less, just multiple realizability again, but here it keys in to an interesting aspect of that concept. It tells us that what is explainable using supervenient features is not always explainable using the associated subvenient features. Here one can make connections traditional issues with philosophy of science.

There are dissenting voices to Putnam’s thesis, but we shall not go any further into the ins and outs of the debate here since it quickly becomes dense and complex. Suffice it to say that supervenience is still “live” in many philosophical debates and will no doubt continue to remain so for some time to come.

6. Adding Mystery to Mystery?

Supervenience is something of a halfway house. It is called upon by some to ground a view according to which certain properties that we think of as “unphysical” are not definable in terms of, or reducible to physical properties and yet are nonetheless connected in some way. It is supposed to somehow avoid the mystery of how physical matters can have a determinative role to play in unphysical properties, without those unphysical properties causing a problem in being materialistically un-kosher. For others, supervenience is a reductive principle, a matter of how the world is and must be.

Many philosophers have complained about the (in)significance of supervenience. Stephen Schiffer suggests that the invocation of supervenience simply moves the explanatory task back a step. How, he asks,

could being told that non-natural moral properties stood in the supervenience relation to physical properties make them any more palatable? On the contrary, invoking a special primitive metaphysical relation of supervenience to explain how non-natural moral properties were related to physical properties was just to add mystery to mystery, to cover one obscurantist move with another.

(Schiffer 1987, p.153-4)

Much recent work has been devoted to decrying the philosophical utility of specific formulations of supervenience, the general idea, or proving equivalences between them. All of the formulations we have seen do no more than to chart certain correlations between properties. They do not tell us anything about dependency or determination between the properties, in the sense of, say, a causal relation. Supervenience directs us to search for the underlying reasons for the correlation—it might not always be there. In the case of the special sciences it isn’t clear that an “underlying reason” is to be found. Kim (1987, p. 167), for example, believes that supervenience is not a “deep” metaphysical relation, but instead is a superficial relation that points to some other ‘deeper’ relation that might explain the superficial pattern of dependency—though more recently Kim has shifted to a reductive view of the relation (see Kim, 2005, for a clear account). In this sense, supervenience is a useful concept, for it can function as a filter on types of relations, letting through those of a certain type. Once we have identified a dependence relation, we can then delve deeper to see what might account for it: causation, mereology, definition, emergence, and so forth. In this sense there is no question of supervenience being an explanatory device, so there is no mystery here; but it can nonetheless be used in the search for explanations.

Supervenience has many useful applications too, in making other areas of philosophy clearer and more navigable. For example, the internalism/externalism distinction concerning mental content [very roughly, externalism is the view that mental content depends on things outside of the mind as well as inside; internalism denies this—saying that only what’s inside matters] can be cast into the endorsement and denial respectively of the following supervenience thesis: the content of a mental state (that is, what it is about) supervenes on certain neurobiological properties (narrow content). On the other hand, the externalist, as can be discerned from the rough characterization above, believes that there is more to content than this: the world plays a role too. One can clarify the distinction between internal and external relations too: an internal relation is one that supervenes on the intrinsic properties of its relata (for example, being heavier than), while this is not true in the case of external relations (for example, being 2 miles away from); it does not matter what something is like for it satisfy this latter relation, but it does for the former. We have seen too that it allows for a definition of physicalism and helps with the puzzle of material coincidence. Surely, if by a concept’s work shall you know it, supervenience deserves the central place that it has found in the philosophers’ toolbox.

7. References and Further Reading

For a more technical and detailed presentation of the concept of supervenience, see McLaughlin and Bennett’s article in the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.

• Beckermann, A., Flohr, H., & Kim, J., (eds.). Emergence or Reduction? Essays on the Prospects of Nonreductive Physicalism. Berlin: Walter de Gruyter, 1992.
• Davidson, D. 1970. “Mental Events.” In D. Davidson (ed.), Essays on Actions and Events, 1980: 207-225.
• Davidson, D. “The Material Mind.” In P. Suppes (ed.), Logic, Methodology and the Philosophy of Science. North-Holland. Reprinted in Essays on Action and Events (Oxford University Press, 1980).
• Fodor, J. “Special Sciences, or the Disunity of Science as a Working Hypothesis.” Synthese, 1974, 28: 97-115.
• Hare, R.M. The Language of Morals. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1952.
• Hellman, G. & Thompson, F. “Physicalism, Ontology, Determination, and Reduction,” The Journal of Philosophy, 1975, 72: 551-64.
• Horgan, T. “From Supervenience to Superdupervenience: Meeting the Demands of a Material World.” Mind, 1993, 102: 555-86.
• Horgan, T. (ed.) Southern Journal of Philosophy 22: The Spindel Conference 1983 Supplement. Supervenience, 1984.
• Jackson, F. From Metaphysics to Ethics. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1998.
• Kim, J. Supervenience, or Something Near Enough. Princeton University Press, 2005.
• Kim, J. Supervenience and Mind. Cambridge University Press, 1993.
• Kim, J. “Concepts of Supervenience.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 1984, 45, 2: 153-176.
• Kim, J. “Supervenience as a Philosophical Concept.” Reprinted in J. Kim, Supervenience and Mind, 1993 (1990): 131-160.
• Kim, J. “’Strong’ and ‘Global’ Supervenience Revisited.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 1987, 48, 2: 315-326.
• Lewis, D.K. The Plurality of Worlds. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1986.
• Lewis, D. K. “Reduction of Mind.” In D. Lewis (ed.), Papers in Metaphysics and Epistemology. Cambridge University Press, 1999 (1994): 291-324.
• McLaughlin, B. & Bennett, K. “Supervenience.” The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Fall 2005 Edition), edited by Edward N. Zalta.
• McLaughlin, B.P. “The Rise and Fall of British Emergentism.” In A. Beckermann et al. (eds.), Emergence or Reduction? Essays on the Prospects of Nonreductive Physicalism. Walter de Gruyter, 1992: 49-93.
• McLaughlin, B.P. “Varieties of Supervenience.” In E. Savellos & U. Yalcin (eds.), Supervenience: New Essays. Cambridge University Press, 1995: 16-59.
• Moore, G.E. Philosophical Studies. London: Routledge, 1922.
• Paull, C.P. & Sider, T.R. 1992. “In Defense of Global Supervenience,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 32, 1992: 830-45.
• Post, J. F. “Comment on Teller.” In Horgan (ed.), The Spindel Conference 1983 Supplement. Supervenience, 1984: 163-167.
• Putnam, H. “Philosophy and our Mental Life.” In Mind, Language, and Reality. Cambridge University Press, 1975.
• E. Savellos & U. Yalcin (eds.), Supervenience: New Essays. Cambridge University Press, 1995.
• Schiffer, S. Remnants of Meaning. Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press, 1987.
• Sober, E. The Nature of Selection: Evolutionary Theory in Philosophical Focus. University of Chicago Press, 1993.
• Stalnaker, R. “Varieties of Supervenience.” Philosophical Perspectives 10, 1996: 221-241.
• Teller, P. “A Poor Man’s Guide to Supervenience and Determination.” In Horgan (ed.), The Spindel Conference 1983 Supplement. Supervenience, 1984: 137-50.

Author Information

Dean Rickles
Email: drickles@ucalgary.ca
University of Calgary