Self-Consciousness

Philosophical work on self-consciousness has mostly focused on the identification and articulation of specific epistemic and semantic peculiarities of self-consciousness, peculiarities which distinguish it from consciousness of things other than oneself. After drawing certain fundamental distinctions, and considering the conditions for the very possibility of self-consciousness, this article discusses the nature of those epistemic and semantic peculiarities.

The relevant epistemic peculiarities are mainly those associated with the alleged infallibility and self-intimation of self-consciousness. It has sometimes been thought that our consciousness of ourselves may be, under certain conditions, infallible, in the sense that it cannot go wrong: when we believe that some fact about us obtains, it does. It has also sometimes been thought that some forms of consciousness are self-intimating: if a certain fact about us obtains, we are necessarily going to be conscious that it does. These claims have come under heavy attack in more recent philosophical work, but it remains unclear whether some restricted forms of infallibility and self-intimation survive the attack.

The relevant semantic peculiarities have emerged in recent work in philosophy of language and mind. Two of them stand out: the so-called immunity to error through misidentification of our consciousness of ourselves and the special character of self-regarding (or de se) consciousness that cannot be assimilated to other kinds of consciousness. Some philosophers have argued that these are not genuine features of self-consciousness, while others have argued that, although genuine, they are not peculiar to self-consciousness. Other philosophers have defended the proposition that these features are genuine and peculiar to self-consciousness. We will consider the case for these claims in due course.

Table of Contents

1. Introduction
2. Self-Consciousness: Some Distinctions
3. (How) Is Self-Consciousness Possible?
4. Epistemic Peculiarities of Self-Consciousness
5. Semantic Peculiarities of Self-Consciousness
   1. Immunities to Error through Misidentification
   2. Essential Indexicals and De Se Thoughts
6. Conclusion: A General Theory of Self-Consciousness?
7. References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

Throughout our waking life, we are conscious of a variety of things. We are often conscious of other people, of cars, trees, beetles, and other objects around us. We are conscious of their features: their colors, their shapes, and the sound they make. We are conscious of events involving them: car accidents, tree blooming, and so forth.

Sometimes we are also conscious of ourselves, our features, and the events that take place within us. Thus, we may become conscious, in a certain situation, of the fact that we are nervous or uncomfortable. We may become conscious of a rising anxiety, or of a sudden cheerfulness. Sometimes we are conscious of simpler things: that we are seeing red, or that we are thinking of tomorrow’s errands.

In addition, we sometimes have the sense that we are continuously conscious of ourselves going about our business in the world. Thus William James, who was very influential in the early days of experimental, systematic psychology (in addition to being the brother of novelist Henry James and a gifted writer himself), remarked once that “whatever I may be thinking of, I am always at the same time more or less aware of myself, of my personal existence” (James 1961: 42).

These forms of self-consciousness—consciousness of ourselves and our personal existence, of our character traits and standing features, and of the thoughts that occur to us and the feelings that we experience—are philosophically fascinating, inasmuch as they are at once quite mysterious and closest to home. Our scientific theories of astrophysical objects that are incredibly distant from us in both space and time, or of the smallest particles that make up the sub-atomic layer of reality, are mature, sophisticated, and impressive. By contrast, we barely have anything worth the name “scientific theory” for self-consciousness and its various manifestations, in spite of self-consciousness’ being so much more familiar a phenomenon—indeed the most familiar phenomenon of all.

Here, as elsewhere, the immaturity of our scientific understanding of self-consciousness invites philosophical reflection on the topic, and is anyway partly due precisely to deep philosophical puzzles about the nature of self-consciousness. Many philosophers have thought that self-consciousness exhibits certain peculiarities not to be found in consciousness of things other than ourselves, and indeed possibly not to be found anywhere else in nature.

Philosophical work on self-consciousness has thus mostly focused on the identification and articulation of these peculiarities. More specifically, it has sought some epistemic and semantic peculiarities of self-consciousness, that is, peculiarities as regards how we know, and more generally how we represent, ourselves and our internal lives. (In philosophical jargon, “epistemology” is the theory of knowledge and “semantics” is—more or less—the theory of representation.) This entry will accordingly focus on these peculiarities. After drawing certain fundamental distinctions, and considering the conditions for the very possibility of self-consciousness, we will discuss first the nature of the relevant epistemic peculiarities and then (more extensively) the semantic ones.

2. Self-Consciousness: Some Distinctions

Let us start by drawing some distinctions. (The distinctions I will draw are meant as conceptual distinctions. Whether they stand for real differences between the properties putatively picked out by the relevant concepts is a separate matter.) The first important distinction is between self-consciousness as a property of whole individuals and self-consciousness as a property of particular mental states. Thus, when we say “My thought that p is self-conscious” and “I am self-conscious,” the property we ascribe is in all likelihood different. My being self-conscious involves my being conscious of my self. But my thought’s being self-conscious does not involve my thought’s being conscious of its self, since (i) it does not have a self, and (ii) thoughts are not the kind of thing that can be conscious of anything. We may call the property that I have creature self-consciousness and the property that my thought has state self-consciousness.

Another distinction is between consciousness of oneself (one’s self) and consciousness of a particular event or state that occurs within oneself. Compare “I am self-conscious of myself thinking that p” to “I am self-conscious of my thought that p.” The latter involves awareness of a particular thought of mine, but need not involve awareness of self or selfhood. It is a form of self-consciousness in the sense that it is directed inward, and takes as its object an internal state of mine. But it is not a form of self-consciousness in the stronger sense of involving consciousness of self. I will refer to the stronger variety as strong self-consciousness and the weaker as weak self-consciousness. State self-consciousness is consciousness of what happens within oneself, whereas creature self-consciousness is consciousness of oneself proper. (Note, however, that a mental state may be both creature- and state-self-conscious. Thus, if I am conscious of my thought that p as my thought, as a thought of mine, then I am conscious both of my thought and of myself.)

Another traditional distinction, which dates back to Kant, is between consciousness of oneself qua object and consciousness of oneself qua subject. Suppose I am conscious of Budapest (or of Budapest and its odors). I am the subject of the thought, its object is Budapest. But suppose now that I am conscious of myself (or of myself and my feelings). Now I am both the subject and the object of the thought. But although the subject and the object of the thought happen to be the same thing, there is still a conceptual distinction to be made between myself in my capacity as object of thought and myself in my capacity as subject of thought. That is to say, even though there is one entity here, there are two separate concepts for this entity, the self-as-subject concept and the self-as-object concept. To mark this difference, William James (1890) introduced a technical distinction between the I and the me. In its technical use, “I” (and its Mentalese correlate) refers to the self-as-subject, whereas “me” (and its Mentalese correlate) refers to the self-as-object. By “Mentalese correlate,” I mean the expression that would mean the same as “I” and “me” in something like the so-called language of thought (Fodor 1975) or Mentalese.)

Corresponding to these two concepts, or conceptions, of self, there would presumably be two distinct modes of presentation under which a person may be conscious of herself. She may be conscious of herself under the “I” description or under the “me” description. Thus, my state of self-consciousness may employ either the “I” mode of presentation or the “me” mode of presentation. (We could capture the difference, using James’ technical terminology, by distinguishing “I am self-conscious that I think that p” and “I am self-conscious that methinks that p.”) In the latter case, there is a sort of “conceptual distance” between the thing that does the thinking and the thing being thought about. Although I am thinking of myself, I am not thinking of myself as the thing that does the thinking. By contrast, in the former case, I am thinking of myself precisely as the thing that is therewith doing the thinking.

Through Kant’s influence on Husserl, philosophers in the phenomenological tradition have long held that something like consciousness of self-as-subject is a distinct, irreducible, and central aspect of our mental life. Philosophers in the analytic tradition have been more suspicious of it (for exceptions to this rule, see for instance Van Gulick 1988 and Strawson 1997). But the distinction between consciousness of self-as-subject and consciousness of self-as-object might be captured using analytic tools, through a distinction between transitive and intransitive self-consciousness (Kriegel 2003, 2004a). Compare “I am self-conscious of thinking that p” and “I am self-consciously thinking that p.” In the former, transitive form, self-consciousness is construed as a relation between me and my thinking. In the latter, intransitive form, it is construed as a modification of my thinking. That is, in the latter the self-consciousness term (if you will) does not denote a state of standing in a relation to my thought (or my thinking) that p. Rather, it designates the way I am having my thought (or doing my thinking). In transitive self-consciousness, the thought and the state of self-consciousness are treated as two numerically distinct mental states. By contrast, in intransitive self-consciousness, there is no numerical distinction between the thought and the state of self-consciousness: the thought is the state of self-consciousness. The adverb “self-consciously” denotes a way I am having my thought that p. No extra act of self-consciousness takes place after the thought that p occurs. Rather, self-consciously is how the thought that p occurs.

I have been speaking of the self-as-subject in terms of “the thing that does the thinking,” and correspondingly of consciousness of oneself as subject in terms of consciousness of oneself as the thing that does the thinking. But recent work in philosophical psychopathology counsels caution here. Schizophrenics suffering from “thought insertion” and “alien voices” delusions report that they are not in control of their thoughts. Indeed, they often envisage a particular individual who, they claim, is doing the thinking for them, or implants thoughts in their mind. Note that although they do not experience themselves as doing the thinking, they do experience the thinking as happening, in some sense, in them. To account for the experiential difference between doing the thinking and merely hosting the thinking, between authorship of one’s thoughts and mere ownership of them (respectively), some philosophers have drawn a distinction between consciousness of oneself as agent and consciousness of oneself as subject (Campbell 1999, Graham and Stephens 2000). The distinction between self-as-agent and self-as-subject is orthogonal, however, to the distinction between self-as-object and self-as-subject. To avoid confusion, let us suggest a different terminology, that of self-as-author versus self-as-owner, and correspondingly, of consciousness of oneself as author of one’s thoughts and consciousness of oneself as owner of one’s thoughts. To be sure, in the normal go of things, ownership and authorship are inseparable. But the pathological cases show that there is daylight between the two notions.

Another important distinction is between propositional self-consciousness and non-propositional self-consciousness. There is no doubt that there is such a thing as propositional self-consciousness: consciousness that some self-related proposition obtains. Presumably, such self-consciousness has conceptual content. But a strong case can be made that there is a form of self-consciousness that is sub-propositional, as it were, and has non-conceptual content (Bermúdez 1998). When a report of self-consciousness uses a “that” clause, as we just did, it necessarily denotes propositional self-consciousness. But when it does not, as is the case, for instance, with “I am self-conscious of thinking that p,” it is left open whether it is propositional or non-propositional self-consciousness that is denoted. That is, “I am self-conscious of thinking that p” is compatible with, but does not entail, “I am self-conscious that I am thinking that p.” In any case, the terminology leaves it open whether there is a non-propositional or non-conceptual form of self-consciousness.

Other distinctions can certainly be drawn. I have restricted myself to those that will play a role in the discussion to follow. They are five:

(a) State self-consciousness versus creature self-consciousness
(b) Strong versus weak self-consciousness
(c) Transitive versus intransitive self-consciousness
(d) Consciousness of self-as-object versus consciousness of self-as-subject
(e) Consciousness of self-as-author versus consciousness of self-as-owner

As I warned at the opening, these distinctions are meant as conceptual ones. This is doubly significant. First, the fact that there is a distinction between two concepts does not entail that there is a difference between the putative properties picked out by these concepts. Second, the existence of a concept does not entail the existence of the property putatively picked out by that concept. In fact, philosophers have questioned the very existence of self-consciousness.

3. (How) Is Self-Consciousness Possible?

Perhaps the best known philosophical threat to the very possibility of self-consciousness hails from Hume’s remarks in the Treatise of Human Nature (I, IV, vi): “For my part, when I enter most intimately into what I call myself, I always stumble on some particular perception or other… I never can catch myself without a perception, and never can observe anything but the perception.”

This passage makes two separate claims, of different degrees of skepticism. The modest claim is:

(MC) Upon “turning into” oneself, one cannot “catch” oneself without a particular mental state.

MC rules out the possibility of a mental state whose sole object is the self. But though it disallows catching oneself without a perception, it does not disallow catching oneself with a perception. Hume makes the latter, stronger, immodest claim next, however:

(IC) Upon “turning into” oneself, one cannot “catch” anything but particular mental states.

IC rules out the possibility of any consciousness of one’s self. That is, it rules out the possibility of creature self-consciousness, allowing only for state self-consciousness.

In assessing Hume’s claims, particularly the immodest one, we must ask, first, what did Hume expect to catch? And second, what sort of catching did he have in mind?

One way to deny the possibility of consciousness of oneself is to reject the existence of a self of which one might be conscious. But the inexistence of a self is not a sufficient condition for the impossibility of self-consciousness: there could still be thoroughly and systematically illusory experience of selfhood that gives rise to a form of (illusory) self-consciousness. Nor is such rejection a necessary condition for the impossibility of self-consciousness. Hume himself not only countenanced the self, he offered a theory of it, namely, the bundle theory. What Hume rejected was the existence of a substantival self, a self that is more than just a stream of consciousness and a sum of experiences. What he rejected is the reifying conception of the self according to which the self is an object among others in the world, a substrate that supports the internal goings-on unfolding therein but is distinct from, and somehow stands above, these proceedings. This rejection is shared today by several philosophers (see, for example, Dennett 1991).

This suggests an answer to our first question, concerning what Hume had expected to catch upon turning into himself. What he expected to catch is a self-substance (if you please). It is unclear, however, why Hume thought that consciousness of oneself, even non-illusory consciousness of oneself, required the existence of a substantival self. Consider how self-consciousness might play out within the framework of Hume’s own bundle theory. Upon turning into herself, a person might become conscious of a particular mental state, say an inexplicable cheerfulness, but become conscious of it as belonging to a larger bundle of mental states, perhaps a bundle that has a certain internal cohesion to it at and across time. In that case, we would be well justified to conceive of this person as conscious of her self.

As for the second question, concerning what sort of “catching” Hume had in mind, it appears that Hume envisioned a quasi-perceptual form of catching. He expected self-consciousness to involve some sort of direct encounter with the self. There is no question that one can believe (or otherwise think purely intellectually) that one is inexplicably cheerful. One can surely entertain purely intellectually the proposition “I am inexplicably cheerful.” But Hume wanted more than that. He wanted to be confronted with his self, by turning inward his mind’s eye, as he would with a chair upon directing his outward gaze in the right direction.

In other words, Hume was working with an introspective model of self-consciousness, according to which self-consciousness involves the employment of an inner sense: an internal mechanism whose operation is analogous in essential respects to the operation of the external senses. This inner sense conception was clearly articulated in Locke: “The other fountain [of] ideas, is the perception of the operations of our own minds within us… And though it be not sense, as having nothing to do with external objects; yet it is very like it, and might properly enough be called internal sense” (Essay Concerning Human Understanding II, i, 4).

The plausibility of the introspective model is very much in contention. Thus, Rosenthal (1986) claims that for self-consciousness to be genuinely analogous with perceptual consciousness, the former would have to exhibit the sort of qualitative character the latter does; but since it does not, it is essentially non-perceptual. On this basis, Rosenthal (2004) proceeds to develop an account of self-consciousness in terms of purely intellectual thoughts about oneself (more specifically, thoughts that are entertained in the presence of their object or referent).

On the other hand, self-consciousness can sometimes have a quality of immediacy about it (and its way of putting us in contact with its objects) that seems to parallel perceptual consciousness. At the same time, philosophers have sometimes charged that self-consciousness is in fact too immediate, indeed unmediated, to be thought of as quasi-perceptual. Thus, Shoemaker (1996) argues that the quasi-perceptual model falters in construing self-consciousness along the lines of the act-object analysis that befits perceptual consciousness. When one is perceptually conscious of a butterfly’s meandering, a distinction is always called for between the act of perceptual consciousness and the meandering butterfly it takes as an object. But when one is conscious of one’s cheerfulness, a parallel distinction between the act of self-consciousness and one’s cheerfulness, supposedly thereby taken as object, is misleading, according to Shoemaker.

One way to interpret Shoemaker’s claim here is that while Hume’s argument may be effective against transitive self-consciousness, it is not against intransitive self-consciousness. Recall that transitive self-consciousness requires a duality of mental states, the state of self-consciousness and the state of (for example) cheerfulness. But in intransitive self-consciousness there is no such duality: there is not a distinction between an act of self-consciousness and a separate object taken by it. On this interpretation, Shoemaker’s claim is that being self-conscious of being cheerful may well be impossible, but it is nonetheless possible to be self-consciously cheerful. We might combine Rosenthal’s and Shoemaker’s perspectives and suggest the view that self-consciousness can come in two varieties: intellectual transitive self-consciousness and intransitive self-consciousness. Both varieties escape the clutches of Hume’s threat: one can catch oneself (with a particular mental state) if the catching is intellectual rather than quasi-perceptual, or if the catching is somehow fused into the particular mental state thereby caught. What Hume showed is that quasi-perceptual transitive self-consciousness is impossible; but this leaves untouched the possibility of intellectual transitive self-consciousness and of intransitive self-consciousness.

In summary, it is quite likely that self-consciousness is indeed possible. But reflecting on the conditions of its possibility puts non-trivial constraints on our conception of self-consciousness. In this respect, contending with Hume’s challenge still proves immensely fruitful. If anything, it wakes us from our dogmatic slumber about self-consciousness and brings up the question of the nature of self-consciousness.

One question regarding the nature of self-consciousness that arises immediately is what is to count as having self-consciousness. Many contemporary cognitive scientists have operationalized the notion of self-consciousness in terms of experiments on mirror self-recognition and the so-called “mark test.” In these experiments, a creature’s forehead is marked with a visible stain. When placed in front of a mirror, some creatures try to wipe off the stain, which suggests that they recognize themselves in the mirror, while others do not (see mainly Gallup 1970, 1977). Successes with the mark test are few and far between. Among primates, it is passed with any consistency only by humans, chimpanzees, and orangutans, but not by gorillas or gibbons (Suarez and Gallup 1981); and even humans do not typically pass it before the age of a year and a half (Amsterdam 1972) and chimpanzees not before three years of age nor after sixteen years of age (Povinelli et al. 1993). Outside the group of primates, it is passed only by bottlenose dolphins (Reiss and Marino 2001) and Asian elephants (Plotnik et al. 2006). However, this operational treatment of self-consciousness is problematic at a number of levels. Most importantly, it is not entirely clear what the true relationship between mirror self-recognition and self-consciousness is. One would need a principled account of the latter in order to clarify that matter. Mirror self-recognition experiments thus cannot take precedence over the search for an independent understanding of self-consciousness.

To that end, let us consider the ways in which self-consciousness has been claimed to be different, special, and sometimes privileged, relative to consciousness of things other than oneself. Early modern philosophers, from Descartes on, have often claimed certain epistemic privileges on behalf of self-consciousness. More recently, twentieth century analytic philosophers have attempted to identify certain semantic peculiarities of self-consciousness. We take those up in turns.

4. Epistemic Peculiarities of Self-Consciousness

In what follows, we will consider, somewhat hastily, about a dozen epistemic peculiarities sometimes attributed to self-consciousness. Traditionally, the most discussed special feature claimed on behalf of self-consciousness is infallibility. According to the doctrine of infallibility, one’s consciousness of oneself is always veridical and accurate. We may say that whenever I am self-conscious of thinking that p, I am indeed thinking that p. It is important to note, however, that to the extent that “self-conscious of” is a success verb, this claim would be trivially true, whereas the point of the doctrine under consideration is that it is true even if “self-conscious of” is not a success verb (or also for any non-success uses of the verb). To bypass this technicality, let us insert parenthetically the qualifier “seemingly” into our formulation of the claim. We may formulate the doctrine of infallibility as follows:

(DIF) If I am (seemingly) self-conscious of thinking that p, then I am thinking that p.

Thus, whenever I believe something about myself and my mental life, the belief is true: things are in fact the way I believe them to be.

The doctrine of infallibility ensures that my beliefs about my mental life are true. A parallel doctrine ensures that such beliefs are (epistemically) justified. We may, without too much injustice to traditional terminology, call this the doctrine of incorrigibility. The traditional notion of incorrigibility is the notion that the subject cannot possibly be corrected by anyone else, which suggests that the subject is in possession of (and makes correct use of) all the relevant evidence. We may thus formulate the doctrine of incorrigibility as follows:

(DIC) If I am (seemingly) self-conscious of thinking that p, then I am justifiably (seemingly) self-conscious of thinking that p.

Whereas according to DIF, whenever I believe something about my mental life, my belief is true, according to DIC, whenever I believe something about my mental life, my belief is justified.

Against the background of the tripartite analysis of knowledge, the conjunction of DIC and DIF would entail a doctrine about self-knowledge in general, namely:

(DIK) If I am (seemingly) self-conscious that I am thinking that p, then I know that I am thinking that p.

That is, if I am in a state of self-consciousness whose content is “I am thinking that p”, then my state of self-consciousness will necessarily qualify as knowledge. Note, however, that the thesis is entailed by DIF and DIC only against the background of the tripartite analysis—though it may be independently true. (If the tripartite analysis is incorrect, as it probably is, then the thesis does not follow from the conjunction of DIC and DIF. But it can still be formulated.)

The three doctrines we have considered claim strong privileges on behalf of self-consciousness. But there are stronger ones. Consider the converse of the doctrine of infallibility. DIF ensures that when I am (seemingly) self-conscious of thinking that p, then I am in fact thinking that p. Its converse is a stronger thesis: whenever I think that p, I am self-conscious of doing so. That is, nothing can pass through the mind without the mind taking notice of it. Having a thought entails being self-conscious of having it. Thoughts are, in this sense, self-intimating. We may formulate the doctrine of self-intimation as follows:

(DSI) If I am thinking that p, then I am self-conscious of thinking that p.

Thus, whenever I think something, I inevitably come to believe (or be aware) that I am. Note that DSI entails DIF, because if I am indeed thinking that p, then my self-consciousness of thinking that p must be true or veridical.

A distinction is sometimes made between weak self-intimation and strong self-intimation (Shoemaker 1996). What we have just considered is the weak variety. The strong variety ensures not only that when I think something, I am aware that I think it, but also that when I do not think something, I am aware that I do not think it. Let us formulate the doctrine of strong self-intimation as follows:

(DSSI) If I am thinking that p, then I am self-conscious of thinking that p; and if I am not thinking that p, then I am self-conscious of not thinking that p.

Strong self-intimation renders the mind in some traditional sense transparent to itself. But the term “transparency” has had such wide currency in recent philosophy of mind that it would be better not to use it in the present context.

Consider now the converse of the doctrine of incorrigibility. It is the thesis that if I think that p, then I am justifiably self-conscious of thinking that p. It also entails DIF, as well as DSI. Again, a strong version can be formulated: If I think that p, then I am justifiably self-conscious of thinking that p; and if I do not think that p, then I am justifiably self-conscious of not thinking that p.

Finally, a parallel thesis could be formulated regarding knowledge: If I think that p, then I know that I think that p. The strong version would be:

(OSC) If I think that p, then I know that I think that p, and if I do not think that p, then I know that I do not think that p.

This last feature is probably the strongest epistemic privilege that could be claimed on behalf of self-consciousness. We may call the associated doctrine the Omniscience of Self-Consciousness. For it is the thesis that one knows everything that happens within one’s mind, and everything that does not.

Freud’s work on the unconscious has all but refuted the above doctrines (see especially Freud 1915). Thus few if any philosophers would defend them today. But many may consider restricted versions of them. The above doctrines are formulated in terms of thoughts, understood as mental states in general. But some theses can be formulated that would restrict the epistemic privileges to a special subset of mental states, such as sensations and feelings, or phenomenally conscious states, or some such. A thus restricted self-intimation thesis might read: if I have a sensation S, then I am self-conscious of having S; or, if I have a phenomenally conscious state S, then I am self-conscious of having S.

Counter-examples to even such appropriately restricted theses have been offered in the literature. Staying with self-intimation, it has been suggested that there are sensations and conscious states that occur without their subject’s awareness. Arguably, I may have a sensation—indeed, a phenomenally conscious sensation—of the refrigerator’s hum without becoming self-conscious of it, let alone of myself hearing it.

Consider now a restricted version of the infallibility doctrine: If I am (seemingly) self-conscious of having sensation S, then I do have sensation S. An alleged counter-example is the fraternity initiation story. Suppose that, blindfolded, I am told that a particular spot on my neck is about to be cut with a razor (this is part of my fraternity initiation); then an ice cube is placed on that spot. At the very first instant, I am likely to be under the impression that I am having a pain sensation, while in reality I am having a coldness sensation. That is, at that instant, I am (seemingly) self-conscious of having a pain sensation but do not in fact have a pain sensation, or so the argument goes (see Horgan and Kriegel 2007).

Another way to restrict the above doctrines is by making their claims weaker. Consider the following variation on self-intimation: If I am thinking that p, then I am self-conscious of thinking. Whereas DSI claims that when I have the thought that p, I am self-conscious not just of having a thought, but of having specifically the thought that p, this variation claims only that I am self-conscious of having a thought—some thought.

We can apply strictures of this type to any of the above doctrines, and some of the resulting theses may be quite plausible. Thus, consider the following thesis:

If I am (seemingly) self-conscious of being in a phenomenally conscious state S, then I am in some phenomenally conscious state.

It is difficult to conceive of a situation in which one is aware of oneself as being in some conscious state when in fact one is in no conscious state (and hence is unconscious). In particular, the fraternity initiation tale does not tell against this thesis: although in the story I am not in fact in a pain state, I am nonetheless in some conscious state.

Such nuanced theses may thus survive modern critiques of the traditional doctrines of epistemic privilege. Their exploration in the literature is, in any case, far from complete. But let us move on to the semantic privileges sometimes imputed on self-consciousness.

5. Semantic Peculiarities of Self-Consciousness

a. Immunities to Error through Misidentification

On the two extremes, the first-person pronoun “I” has been claimed by some to be entirely non-referential (Anscombe 1975) and by others to be the only true form of reference (Chisholm 1976 Ch. 3, and in a more nuanced way, Lewis 1979). Presumably, analogous statements could be made about the concept we use in thought in order to think about ourselves in the first person. For convenience, I will call the relevant concept the Mentalese first-person pronoun, or just the Mentalese “I”. Plausibly, the special features of linguistic self-reference (the way “I” refers) derive from, or at least parallel, corresponding features of self-consciousness, and more specifically mental self-reference (the way the Mentalese “I” refers). In the present context, it is the latter that interest us. Our discussion will focus on two main features. In the next section, we will consider the alleged essential indexicality of self-consciousness (Perry 1979) and irreducibility of de se thoughts (Castañeda 1966, 1967, 1968, 1969). (These terms will be explicated in due course.) The present section considers a semantic peculiarity pointed out by Sydney Shoemaker (1968) under the name “immunity to error through misidentification relative to the first-person pronoun” and related peculiarities discussed by Anscombe (1975), Evans (1982), and others.

When I think about things other than myself, there are two ways in which my thoughts may turn out to be false. Suppose I think that my next-door neighbor is a nice person. I may be wrong about either (i) whether he is a nice person or (ii) who my next-door neighbor is. The first error is one of mispredication, if you will, whereas the second is one of misidentification. Thus, if I mistake my neighbor’s tendency to smile for kindness, when in fact it serves a cynical ploy to lure me into signing an unjust petition against the superintendent, then I make a mistake of the first kind. By contrast, if I mistake the mailman for my next-door neighbor, and think that it is my next-door neighbor who is a nice person, when in fact it is the mailman who is, then I make a mistake of the second kind.

In this sense, my thought that my next-door neighbor is a nice person displays a composite structure, involving identification and predication. We may represent this by saying that my thought has the internal structure “my next-door neighbor is the person smiling at me every morning & the person smiling at me every morning is a nice person”, or more generally “my next-door neighbor is the φ & the φ is a nice person”. This is not to say that when I think that my next-door neighbor is a nice person I am thinking this as a conjunction, or that my thought takes a conjunctive proposition as its object. The above conjunctive representation of my thought is meant just as a device to bring out the fact that my thought has a composite structure. The point is just that my thought has two separable components, an identificational component and a predicational component.

Correspondingly, we can envisage three sorts of semantic peculiarity or privilege. (1) There could be a kind of thought K1, such that if a thought T is of that kind, then T can only be false due to mispredication; thoughts of kind K1 are thus immune to error through misidentification. (2) There could be a kind of thought K2, such that if T is of that kind, then T can only be false due to misidentification; thoughts of kind K2 are thus immune to error through mispredication. (3) There could be a kind of thought K3, such that if T is of that kind, then T can be false due to neither mispredication nor misidentification; thoughts of kind K3 are thus immune to error tout court. The above are just definitions of privileges. It remains to be seen whether any of these definitions is actually satisfied. Shoemaker’s claim is that the first definition is indeed satisfied by a certain subset of thoughts about oneself.

Note that the third peculiarity, immunity to error tout court, is basically infallibility. This way of conceiving of immunity to error through misidentification brings out its relation to the more traditional doctrine of infallibility. Unlike the latter, the doctrine of immunity to error through misidentification does not claim blanket immunity. But it does restrict in a principled manner the ways in which the relevant thoughts may turn out to be false. If I think that I feel angry, then I can be wrong about whether that is a feeling I really have, but I cannot be wrong about whom it is that is allegedly angry.

We said that according to Shoemaker, a certain subset of thoughts about oneself is immune to error through misidentification. What subset? One can think about oneself under any number of descriptions. And some descriptions one may not be aware of as applying to one. Thus, I may think that my mother’s nieceless brother’s only nephew is brown-eyed, without being aware that I am my mother’s nieceless brother’s only nephew. In that case, I think about myself, but not as myself. We might say that I have a thought about myself, but not a self-aware thought about myself. Let us call self-aware thoughts about oneself I-thoughts. According to Shoemaker, some I-thoughts are immune to error through misidentification, namely, those I-thoughts that are directed to one’s mind and mental life, as opposed to one’s body and corporeal life. (To take an example from Wittgenstein, suppose I see in the mirror a tangle of arms and I mistakenly take the nicest one to be mine. I may think to myself “I have a nice arm.” In that case, I may not only be wrong about whether my arm is nice, but also about whom it is that has a nice arm. Such an I-thought, being about my body, is not immune to error through misidentification. But my thoughts about my mind are so immune, claims Shoemaker.) More accurately, as we will see later on, Shoemaker holds that absolute, as opposed to circumstantial, immunity to error through misidentification applies only to mental I-thoughts.

We should distinguish two versions of the doctrine of immunity. According to the first, the relevant I-thoughts cannot be false through misidentification because the identifications they involve are always and necessarily correct; call this the infallible identification (II) version of the doctrine of immunity. According to the second version, the relevant I-thoughts cannot be false through misidentification because they do not involve identification in the first place; call this the identificationless reference (IR) version of the doctrine of immunity. (Brook [2001] speaks of ascriptionless reference, which may also be a good label for the specific feature under consideration.) Both versions claim a certain distinction on behalf of the relevant I-thoughts, but the distinction is very different. The first version claims the distinction of infallible identification, whereas the second one claims the distinction of dispensable identification.

Shoemaker appears to hold the IR version (see, for example, Shoemaker 1968: 558). In some respects this is the more radical version. On the II version, I-thoughts have the same composite structure as other thoughts. When I think that I am amused, the content of my thought has the structure “I am the φ & the φ is amused”. It is just that there is something special about the identificational component in the relevant I-thoughts that makes it impervious to error. Whenever I think that I am the φ, I am. The IR version is more radical. It claims that the relevant I-thoughts do not have the same composite structure as other thoughts—that they are structurally different. More specifically, they lack any identificational component. My thought that I am amused hooks onto me in some direct, identification-free way.

The distinction between these two versions is important, because the burden of argument is very different in each case. To make the case for II, one would have to argue that the relevant self-identifications are infallible. To make the case for IR, by contrast, one would have to argue that the relevant I-thoughts are identification-free. There is also a corresponding difference in explanatory burden. II must explain how is it that certain acts of identification are impervious to error, whereas IR must explain how is it that some acts of reference can dispense with identification altogether (How do they hook onto the right referent without identifying it?).

Shoemaker’s (1968) argument for IR, in its barest outlines, proceeds as follows. Suppose (for reductio) that every self-reference required self-identification. Then every thought with a content “I am F” would have the internal structure “I am the φ & the φ is F”. That is, ascertaining that one is F would require that one identify oneself as the φ and then establish that the φ is F. But this would entail that the same would apply to “I am the φ”: it would have to have the internal structure “I am the ψ & the ψ is the φ”. That is, in order to ascertain that one is the φ, one would have to first identify oneself as the ψ and then establish that the ψ is the φ. And so on ad infinitum. To avert infinite regress, at least some self-reference must be identification-free.

To claim that immunity to error through misidentification is a peculiarity of self-consciousness is to claim that it is a feature peculiar to self-consciousness. One can deny this claim in two ways: (i) by arguing that it is not a feature of self-consciousness, and (ii) by arguing that it is not peculiar to self-consciousness (that is, although it is a feature of self-consciousness, it is also a feature of other forms of consciousness).

Several philosophers have pursued (i). Perhaps the most widely discussed argument is the following, due to Gareth Evans (1982: 108). On the basis of seeing in a mirror a large number of hands, one of which is touching a piece of cloth, and a certain feeling I have in my hand, as of touching a piece of cloth, I come to think that I am feeling a piece of cloth. But this is false, and false due to misidentification: I am not the one who is feeling the piece of cloth. Therefore, there are states of self-consciousness that are not immune to error through misidentification; so such immunity is not a feature of self-consciousness as such.

Arguably, however, this is not a pure case of self-consciousness. The thought in question involves self-consciousness, but it is also partly consciousness of something external, and it is the latter part of it that leads to the error. Consider the difference between the thought “I am feeling a piece of cloth” and the thought “I am having a feeling as of a piece of cloth,” or even more perspicuously, “I am having a cloth-ish feeling.” It is clear that if it turns out to be erroneous that I am having a cloth-ish feeling, it is not because I have misidentified myself in the mirror. Indeed, what I see in the mirror is entirely irrelevant to the truth of my thought that I am having a cloth-ish feeling.

More often, philosophers have pursued (ii), arguing that immunity to error through misidentification is not peculiar to self-consciousness. Evans (1982) himself, for instance, argued that thoughts about one’s body, and even certain perceptions and perception-based judgments, can be equally immune to error through misidentification, indeed be identification-free. When I think that my legs are crossed, my thought seems to be immune to error through misidentification: it cannot turn out that someone’s legs are indeed crossed, but not mine.

One response would be to claim that thoughts about one’s own body are a genuine form of self-consciousness, albeit bodily self-consciousness. But another would be to draw finer distinctions between kinds of immunity and attach a specific sort of immunity to self-consciousness. Shoemaker (1968) distinguished between absolute and circumstantial immunity to error through misidentification, claiming that only the relevant I-thoughts exhibit the absolute variety. In the same vein, McGinn (1983) distinguishes between derivative and non-derivative immunity to error through misidentification, and Pryor (1999) between de re misidentification and which-object misidentification, both claiming that only the relevant I-thoughts exhibit the latter. However, Stanley (1998) erects a considerable challenge to all these attempts. The issue of whether some kind of immunity to error through misidentification is a peculiarity of self-consciousness is still very much debated.

Let us end this section with a few general points. First, immunity to error through misidentification is at bottom a semantic, not an epistemic, peculiarity. It concerns the special way the Mentalese “I” hooks onto its referent. Thus, immunity to error through misidentification is not to be confused with immunity to error through unjustified identification, immunity to unjustifiedness through misidentification, or immunity to unjustifiedness through unjustified identification—all of which would be epistemic peculiarities.

Second, immunity to error through misidentification is a semantic peculiarity of strong self-consciousness, not weak self-consciousness, since it involves essentially consciousness of oneself, not just consciousness of a particular thought of one. So, if I am (seemingly) self-conscious of thinking that p, it may be that I am not thinking that p, but only because it is not thinking that p that I am doing—not because it is not I who is doing the thinking.

Third, Shoemaker’s “discovery” of immunity preceded the Kripkean revolution in philosophy of language and more generally the theory of reference. A question therefore arises concerning the relation between his claim that self-reference is identification-free and Kripke’s claim that many kinds of reference are direct or rigid. Direct reference—which is commonly thought to characterize proper names, natural kind terms, and indexicals—is reference that is sense-free, if you will: it does not employ a sense, or mode of presentation, in hooking onto the referent. What is the relation, then, between sense-free reference and identification-free reference?

A natural thought is that some (perhaps all) senses are identifications, and so identification-freedom is simply one special case of sense-freedom. If so, Shoemaker’s “discovery” may be just a foreshadowing of the Kripkean revolution: it is the discovery of the possibility of sense-free reference, but with an overly restrictive assessment of its scope (where Kripke claimed that all sorts of representational devices are sense-free, Shoemaker thought that only “I” is).

But there is also another view of the matter. Kripke’s directly referential terms do not employ senses, but they do employ reference-fixers. When I think that Tom is generous, there is something that fixes the reference of my Mentalese concept for Tom—for example, the fact that Tom is the salient person called “Tom.” This reference-fixing fact is not necessarily something I am aware of, which is why it does not qualify as a sense. But it is nonetheless operative in the reference-fixing. When thinking that Tom is generous, I am performing an identification of Tom, albeit an implicit identification, one of which I am not explicitly aware. One way to interpret Shoemaker’s claim is that self-reference does not even employ a reference-fixer. It is not only sense-free, but also reference-fixer-free. It is not only that the relevant I-thoughts hook onto oneself without the subject performing an explicit identification, but they hook onto oneself without the subject performing any identification, explicit or implicit. If so, Shoemaker’s claim is more radical than Kripkean direct reference: identification-free reference is not just direct, it is entirely unmediated.

A similar point can be made with respect to Elizabeth Anscombe’s claim that, unlike all other expressions, “I” cannot fail to refer. So I-thoughts are “secure from reference-failure” (Anscombe 1975: 149). That is, such I-thoughts as “I am feeling hungry” are, in effect, immune to error through reference-failure. What is the relation between immunity to error through misidentification and immunity to error through reference-failure? One view would be that there is no difference—the two are the same. But this would make Shoemaker’s ultimate claim that the relevant I-thoughts enjoy identification-freedom the same as Anscombe’s ultimate claim that they enjoy reference-freedom. Shoemaker states explicitly that “I” does refer, though in some identification-free manner. One way to make sense of this is by appeal, again, to freedom from reference-fixing. Here identification-free reference is construed as reference-fixer-free reference. On this view, the Mentalese “I” is referential, but it has the peculiarity that its reference is unmediated by any reference-fixing mechanism.

A crucial issue that remains unaddressed is how reference-fixer-free reference is possible. How can a representational item “find” its referent without any mechanism ensuring a connection between them? Any general theory of self-consciousness that embraces Shoemaker’s IR version of the doctrine of immunity must explain the possibility of reference unfixed. To my knowledge, this challenge remains to be broached in the literature.

b. Essential Indexicals and De Se Thoughts

In the last section we saw that, when one employs the Mentalese “I” in thought, one’s thought probably acquires certain unusual features. In this section, we will see that in certain thoughts one cannot avoid employing the Mentalese “I.” This, too, is a semantic peculiarity, albeit of a different order.

In a well-known story, John Perry tells of his experience following a trail of sugar in a supermarket and thinking to himself “The shopper with the torn bag of sugar is making a mess.” Upon realizing that he is the person with the torn bag, he forms a new thought, “I am making a mess.” This thought is new: its functional role is different from the one of the original thought. Perry’s subsequent actions can be explained by ascribing to him this I-thought in a way they cannot by ascribing to him the “I”-free thought. Perry calls beliefs such as “I am making a mess” locating beliefs, and argues that such beliefs cannot avoid employing Mentalese indexicals. There is no way to think the same thought without employing the Mentalese “I.” Such a thought thus contains an essential indexical, or more accurately, essentially contains an indexical reference. In this sense, these thoughts are irreducible to any other, non-indexical kind of thought.

It should be emphasized that the point here is not that such I-thoughts cannot be reported by anyone other than the subject, or that such first-person reports cannot be matched by third-person reports. In direct speech (oratio recta), one might report Perry’s I-thought as follows:

(1) Perry thinks “I am making a mess”.

The same report could be made more naturally in indirect speech (oratio obliqua). In order to do so, however, one would need to employ what linguists call an indirect reflexive. Some languages apparently contain unique words for the indirect reflexives. English does not. But fortunately, the English indirect reflexives were discerned in the late 1960s by Hector-Neri Castañeda (curiously perhaps, not himself a native speaker). Castañeda showed that (1) is equivalent to:

(2) Perry thinks that he himself is making a mess.

At least this is so for paradigmatic uses of “he himself.” (There are also uses of “he” that function in this way, but these are more rare. And there are probably—somewhat unusual—uses of “he himself” that do not function this way. Castañeda introduced the term “he*” as a term that behaves as an indirect reflexive in all its uses.) Castañeda called reports of this sort de se (that is, of oneself) and claimed that de se reports cannot be paraphrased into any de dicto or de re reports, and are thus semantically unique and irreducible. Correlatively, the mental states reported in de se reports, to which we may refer as de se thoughts, are irreducible to mental states reported in de dicto and de re reports. In a “material mode of speech,” this means that states of self-consciousness form an irreducible class of mental states.

Note, in any case, that Castañeda’s thesis is a generalization from Perry’s thesis about reports of one’s own self-conscious states (that is, first-person reports) to all reports of self-conscious states, including reports of others’ self-conscious states (third-person reports). According to Castañeda’s thesis, self-reference is irreducible to either de dicto or de re reference to what is in fact oneself. Castañeda argues for this by showing that the indirect reflexives “he himself,” “she herself,” and so forth, have special logical features. Thus (2) cannot be paraphrased into any (indirect-speech) report that does not employ “he himself.” Consider the following de dicto report:

(3) Perry thinks that the author of “The Essential Indexical” is making a mess.

The truth conditions of (3) and (2) are different, since the latter does not entail the former: Perry may be unaware that it is he who is the author of “The Essential Indexical” (that is, that he himself is the author of “The Essential Indexical”). So (3) and (2) are not equivalent. Presumably, the same goes for any other description “the φ” that picks out Perry uniquely—it could always be that Perry is unaware that he himself is the φ.

Consider next a de dicto report with a proper name instead of a definite description:

(4) Perry thinks that Perry is making a mess.

Again, Perry may be unaware that it is he who is Perry. Therefore, the truth conditions of (2) and (4) are different, and the two are not equivalent. What about the de re versions of (3) and (4)? These can be obtained, in fact, by reading “the author of ‘The Essential Indexical’” and “Perry” in (3) and (4) as used, in Donnellan’s (1966) terms, referentially rather than attributively. But the de re versions are more perspicuously put as follows:

(5) Perry thinks, of the author of “The Essential Indexical,” that he is making a mess.

(6) Perry thinks, of Perry, that he is making a mess.

Boër and Lycan (1980), for instance, claim that (2) is equivalent to (6). But Castañeda argued that it is not. The argument proceeded as follows. The conjunction of (4) and “Perry exists” entails (6), and likewise, the conjunction of (3) and “The author of ‘The Essential Indexical’ exists” entails (5). But neither the conjunction of (4) and “Perry exists,” nor the conjunction of (3) and “The author of ‘The Essential Indexical’ exists,” entails (2). Thus, “Perry thinks that Perry is making a mess” and “Perry exists” do not entail “Perry thinks that he himself is making a mess.” Therefore, (2) has a different logical force from, and is thus not equivalent to, either (6) or (5). There is perhaps only one approach that may plausibly succeed in reducing de se reports to de dicto ones. It is the approach Eddy Zemach (1985) refers to as neo-Cartesian, and according to which the thought “I am making a mess” is equivalent to:

(7) The thinker of this very thought is making a mess.

On this approach, (2) is equivalent to:

(8) Perry thinks that the thinker of that very thought is making a mess.

In terms of the distinction drawn in §1, the idea here is that self-consciousness is essentially indexical and irreducibly de se inasmuch as it is consciousness of self-as-subject. On this approach, one’s self-conscious thought refers to oneself by referring to itself. In other words, one’s self-reference is mediated by the self-reference of one’s thought.

The emerging view is quite natural. Just as an utterance of the word “I” refers to whoever betokened that very utterance, so a deployment of the Mentalese “I” refers to whoever betokened that very deployment, that is, the thinker of that very I-thought. It may be that “I” is not synonymous with “the utterer of this very word,” but surely the latter functions as the reference-fixer of the former. Likewise, even if the Mentalese “I” is not synonymous with a Mentalese “the thinker of this very thought,” the latter still functions as the reference-fixer of the former.

One problem with the neo-Cartesian approach, however, is that it replaces one sort of indexical self-reference with another. It replaces the thinker’s self-reference with the self-reference of his or her thought. We are thus left with an unexplained essential and irreducible indexical self-reference.

Castañeda actually discussed the neo-Cartesian approach before it was expounded by Zemach, and found a different fault in it. According to Castañeda, what dooms the approach is “the fact, which philosophers (especially Hume and Kant) have known all along, that there is no object of experience that one could perceive as the self that is doing the perceiving” (Castañeda 1966: 64). Whether or not it reflects Hume’s or Kant’s thinking on self-consciousness, the idea is that the subject of thought cannot be thought about as such. Castañeda is effectively denying here the possibility of consciousness of oneself-as-subject. When I think about myself and my mental life, what I am thinking of thereby becomes the object of my thought. I cannot think of myself qua the subject of thought, that is, the thing that does the thinking. The self-as-subject is in this way elusive. As Ryle (1949) put it, trying to think of the self-as-subject is like trying to hop on one’s own shadow: every time you take a step back in order to observe your self-as-subject, your self-as-subject takes a step back with you, as it were.

This objection may apply with more force to what we called in §1 transitive self-consciousness than to what we called intransitive self-consciousness. Even if I cannot become self-conscious of thinking that the thinker of this very thought is cheerful, it does not follow that I cannot self-consciously think that the thinker of this very thought is cheerful. This is because, as pointed out in §1, self-consciously thinking that p, unlike being self-conscious of thinking that p, does not involve two separate states, such that the second one takes the first one as its object. That is, intransitive self-consciousness does not involve “taking a step back,” which is required for Ryle’s regress to get going.

We cannot pursue this issue here with any seriousness. It seems clear, however, that if de se thoughts are not irreducible to de dicto thoughts, it would probably be because the Mentalese “I” can be somehow understood in terms of reference to the subject of the very act of referring. Either way, there is almost certainly some semantic peculiarity to be reckoned with here. The question is merely how best to characterize that peculiarity.

6. Conclusion: A General Theory of Self-Consciousness?

Discussions of the peculiarities of self-consciousness, both epistemic and semantic, mostly focus on whether a given alleged peculiarity in fact obtains or is merely alleged. But as Brook (2001) stresses, these peculiarities must also be explained, or accounted for, in the context of a general theory of self-consciousness. With a handful of exceptions (for example, Bermúdez 1998) current work on self-consciousness does not appear to address the need for a general theory thereof. Instead, it rests content with a piecemeal treatment of each alleged peculiarity in separation from the rest. Sooner or later, however, this will have to be rectified by a reorientation or reorganization of research in this area.

The alleged peculiarities of self-consciousness will then come in handy. For they are useful in providing explananda for any putative theory of self-consciousness, or data against which to “test” such a theory (this is indeed how Bermúdez 1998 proceeds). This is not to say that they must be the only explananda. Such empirical data as are gleaned from mirror self-recognition experiments and other studies of animal metacognition should also be accommodated by a philosophical theory of self-consciousness.

My suggestion is that a general theory of self-consciousness could be configured in two steps. The first would be to determine which of the alleged epistemic and semantic peculiarities of self-consciousness in fact obtain. The second would be to devise an account of the metaphysical structure, as well as of the cognitive mechanisms underlying the formation, of states of self-consciousness, such that the relevant account would explain, by predicting or “retrodicting” (as C. S. Peirce puts it), the obtaining of just those peculiarities.

The peculiarities discerned in the second half of the last century are so subtle that we should be open to the idea that there may be further peculiarities which have yet to be “discovered.” There may also be familiar peculiarities that have not been recognized as such. Thus, some recent authors have drawn a new connection between self-consciousness and Moore’s paradox, which presents the challenge of understanding the logical impropriety of beliefs or thoughts of the form “p & I do not believe that p” (see Moran 2001, Kriegel 2004b, and Fernández 2006). Thus it may well be that Moore’s Paradox is at bottom another peculiarity of self-consciousness.

All this suggests that, as far as philosophical research on self-consciousness is concerned, the hardest, but in a way the most interesting, challenges are yet to be faced. At present, the philosophical literature on self-consciousness is quite disparate in the respects mentioned above. But it invites unification under a systematic framework for a general theory of self-consciousness. The most philosophically rewarding work on self-consciousness is still ahead of us.

7. References and Further Reading

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• Bermúdez, J. L. 1998. The Paradox of Self-Consciousness. Cambridge MA: MIT Press.
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• Boër, S. and W. G. Lycan. 1986. Knowing Who. Cambridge MA: MIT Press.
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• BonJour, L. 2001. “Towards a Defense of Foundationalism.” In M. DePaul (ed.), Resurrecting Old-Fashioned Foundationalism. Lanham, MD: Roiwman and Littlefield.
• Brook, A. 2001. “Kant, Self-Awareness and Self-Reference.” In Brook and DeVidi 2001.
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• Castañeda, H.-N. 1966. “‘He’: A Study in the Logic of Self-Consciousness.” Ratio 8: 130-157. Reprinted in Brook and DeVidi 2001.
• Castañeda, H.-N. 1967. “The Logic of Self-Knowledge.” Noûs 1: 9-21.
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• Castañeda, H.-N. 1969. “On the Phenomno-Logic of the I.” In Proceedings of the 14th International Congress of Philosophy III. Reprinted in Cassam 1994.
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• Horgan, T., J. Tienson, and G. Graham 2006. “Internal-World Skepticism and the Self-Presentational Nature of Phenomenal Consciousness.” In U. Kriegel and K. Williford (eds.), Self-Representational Approaches to Consciousness. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
• Horgan, T. and U. Kriegel 2007. “Phenomenal Epistemology: What is Consciousness that We may Know It so Well?” Forthcoming in Philosophical Issues 17.
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Author Information

Uriah Kriegel
Email: theuriah@gmail.com
University of Arizona
U. S. A.

Artificial Intelligence

Artificial intelligence (AI) would be the possession of intelligence, or the exercise of thought, by machines such as computers. Philosophically, the main AI question is “Can there be such?” or, as Alan Turing put it, “Can a machine think?” What makes this a philosophical and not just a scientific and technical question is the scientific recalcitrance of the concept of intelligence or thought and its moral, religious, and legal significance. In European and other traditions, moral and legal standing depend not just on what is outwardly done but also on inward states of mind. Only rational individuals have standing as moral agents and status as moral patients subject to certain harms, such as being betrayed. Only sentient individuals are subject to certain other harms, such as pain and suffering. Since computers give every outward appearance of performing intellectual tasks, the question arises: “Are they really thinking?” And if they are really thinking, are they not, then, owed similar rights to rational human beings? Many fictional explorations of AI in literature and film explore these very questions.

A complication arises if humans are animals and if animals are themselves machines, as scientific biology supposes. Still, “we wish to exclude from the machines” in question “men born in the usual manner” (Alan Turing), or even in unusual manners such as in vitro fertilization or ectogenesis. And if nonhuman animals think, we wish to exclude them from the machines, too. More particularly, the AI thesis should be understood to hold that thought, or intelligence, can be produced by artificial means; made, not grown. For brevity’s sake, we will take “machine” to denote just the artificial ones. Since the present interest in thinking machines has been aroused by a particular kind of machine, an electronic computer or digital computer, present controversies regarding claims of artificial intelligence center on these.

Accordingly, the scientific discipline and engineering enterprise of AI has been characterized as “the attempt to discover and implement the computational means” to make machines “behave in ways that would be called intelligent if a human were so behaving” (John McCarthy), or to make them do things that “would require intelligence if done by men” (Marvin Minsky). These standard formulations duck the question of whether deeds which indicate intelligence when done by humans truly indicate it when done by machines: that’s the philosophical question. So-called weak AI grants the fact (or prospect) of intelligent-acting machines; strong AI says these actions can be real intelligence. Strong AI says some artificial computation is thought. Computationalism says that all thought is computation. Though many strong AI advocates are computationalists, these are logically independent claims: some artificial computation being thought is consistent with some thought not being computation, contra computationalism. All thought being computation is consistent with some computation (and perhaps all artificial computation) not being thought.

Table of Contents

1. Thinkers, and Thoughts
   1. What Things Think?
   2. Thought: Intelligence, Sentience, and Values
2. The Turing Test
3. Appearances of AI
   1. Computers
      1. Prehistory
      2. Theoretical Interlude: Turing Machines
      3. From Theory to Practice
   2. “Existence Proofs” of AI
      1. Low-Level Appearances and Attributions
      2. Theorem Proving and Mathematical Discovery
      3. Game Playing
      4. Planning
      5. Robots
      6. Knowledge Representation (KR)
      7. Machine Learning (ML)
      8. Neural Networks and Connectionism
      9. Natural Language Processing (NLP)
   3. On the Behavioral Evidence
4. Against AI: Objections and Replies
   1. Computationalism and Competing Theories of Mind
   2. Arguments from Behavioral Disabilities
      1. The Mathematical Objection
      2. The Rule-bound Inflexibility or “Brittleness” of Machine Behavior
      3. The Lack of Feelings Objection
      4. Scalability and Disunity Worries
   3. Arguments from Subjective Disabilities
      1. Free Will: Lady Lovelace’s Objection?
      2. Intentionality: Searle’s Chinese Room Argument
      3. Consciousness: Subjectivity and Qualia
5. Conclusion: Not the Last Word
6. References and Further Reading

1. Thinkers, and Thoughts

a. What Things Think?

Intelligence might be styled the capacity to think extensively and well. Thinking well centrally involves apt conception, true representation, and correct reasoning. Quickness is generally counted a further cognitive virtue. The extent or breadth of a thing’s thinking concerns the variety of content it can conceive, and the variety of thought processes it deploys. Roughly, the more extensively a thing thinks, the higher the “level” (as is said) of its thinking. Consequently, we need to distinguish two different AI questions:

1. Can machines think at all?
2. Can machine intelligence approach or surpass the human level?

In Computer Science, work termed “AI” has traditionally focused on the high-level problem; on imparting high-level abilities to “use language, form abstractions and concepts” and to “solve kinds of problems now reserved for humans” (McCarthy et al. 1955); abilities to play intellectual games such as checkers (Samuel 1954) and chess (Deep Blue); to prove mathematical theorems (GPS); to apply expert knowledge to diagnose bacterial infections (MYCIN); and so forth. More recently there has arisen a humbler seeming conception – “behavior-based” or “nouvelle” AI – according to which seeking to endow embodied machines, or robots, with so much as “insect level intelligence” (Brooks 1991) counts as AI research. Where traditional human-level AI successes impart isolated high-level abilities to function in restricted domains, or “microworlds,” behavior-based AI seeks to impart coordinated low-level abilities to function in unrestricted real-world domains.

Still, to the extent that what is called “thinking” in us is paradigmatic for what thought is, the question of human level intelligence may arise anew at the foundations. Do insects think at all? And if insects … what of “bacteria level intelligence” (Brooks 1991a)? Even “water flowing downhill,” it seems, “tries to get to the bottom of the hill by ingeniously seeking the line of least resistance” (Searle 1989). Don’t we have to draw the line somewhere? Perhaps seeming intelligence – to really be intelligence – has to come up to some threshold level.

b. Thought: Intelligence, Sentience, and Values

Much as intentionality (“aboutness” or representation) is central to intelligence, felt qualities (so-called “qualia”) are crucial to sentience. Here, drawing on Aristotle, medieval thinkers distinguished between the “passive intellect” wherein the soul is affected, and the “active intellect” wherein the soul forms conceptions, draws inferences, makes judgments, and otherwise acts. Orthodoxy identified the soul proper (the immortal part) with the active rational element. Unfortunately, disagreement over how these two (qualitative-experiential and cognitive-intentional) factors relate is as rife as disagreement over what things think; and these disagreements are connected. Those who dismiss the seeming intelligence of computers because computers lack feelings seem to hold qualia to be necessary for intentionality. Those like Descartes, who dismiss the seeming sentience of nonhuman animals because he believed animals don’t think, apparently hold intentionality to be necessary for qualia. Others deny one or both necessities, maintaining either the possibility of cognition absent qualia (as Christian orthodoxy, perhaps, would have the thought-processes of God, angels, and the saints in heaven to be), or maintaining the possibility of feeling absent cognition (as Aristotle grants the lower animals).

2. The Turing Test

While we don’t know what thought or intelligence is, essentially, and while we’re very far from agreed on what things do and don’t have it, almost everyone agrees that humans think, and agrees with Descartes that our intelligence is amply manifest in our speech. Along these lines, Alan Turing suggested that if computers showed human level conversational abilities we should, by that, be amply assured of their intelligence. Turing proposed a specific conversational test for human-level intelligence, the “Turing test” it has come to be called. Turing himself characterizes this test in terms of an “imitation game” (Turing 1950, p. 433) whose original version “is played by three people, a man (A), a woman (B), and an interrogator (C) who may be of either sex. The interrogator stays in a room apart from the other two. … The object of the game for the interrogator is to determine which of the other two is the man and which is the woman. The interrogator is allowed to put questions to A and B [by teletype to avoid visual and auditory clues]. … . It is A’s object in the game to try and cause C to make the wrong identification. … The object of the game for the third player (B) is to help the interrogator.” Turing continues, “We may now ask the question, `What will happen when a machine takes the part of A in this game?’ Will the interrogator decide wrongly as often when the game is being played like this as he does when the game is played between a man and a woman? These questions replace our original, `Can machines think?'” (Turing 1950)  The test setup may be depicted this way:

This test may serve, as Turing notes, to test not just for shallow verbal dexterity, but for background knowledge and underlying reasoning ability as well, since interrogators may ask any question or pose any verbal challenge they choose. Regarding this test Turing famously predicted that “in about fifty years’ time [by the year 2000] it will be possible to program computers … to make them play the imitation game so well that an average interrogator will have no more than 70 per cent. chance of making the correct identification after five minutes of questioning” (Turing 1950); a prediction that has famously failed. As of the year 2000, machines at the Loebner Prize competition played the game so ill that the average interrogator had 100 percent chance of making the correct identification after five minutes of questioning (see Moor 2001).

It is important to recognize that Turing proposed his test as a qualifying test for human-level intelligence, not as a disqualifying test for intelligence per se (as Descartes had proposed); nor would it seem suitably disqualifying unless we are prepared (as Descartes was) to deny that any nonhuman animals possess any intelligence whatsoever. Even at the human level the test would seem not to be straightforwardly disqualifying: machines as smart as we (or even smarter) might still be unable to mimic us well enough to pass. So, from the failure of machines to pass this test, we can infer neither their complete lack of intelligence nor, that their thought is not up to the human level. Nevertheless, the manners of current machine failings clearly bespeak deficits of wisdom and wit, not just an inhuman style. Still, defenders of the Turing test claim we would have ample reason to deem them intelligent – as intelligent as we are – if they could pass this test.

3. Appearances of AI

The extent to which machines seem intelligent depends first, on whether the work they do is intellectual (for example, calculating sums) or manual (for example, cutting steaks): herein, an electronic calculator is a better candidate than an electric carving knife. A second factor is the extent to which the device is self-actuated (self-propelled, activated, and controlled), or “autonomous”: herein, an electronic calculator is a better candidate than an abacus. Computers are better candidates than calculators on both headings. Where traditional AI looks to increase computer intelligence quotients (so to speak), nouvelle AI focuses on enabling robot autonomy.

a. Computers

i. Prehistory

In the beginning, tools (for example, axes) were extensions of human physical powers; at first powered by human muscle; then by domesticated beasts and in situ forces of nature, such as water and wind. The steam engine put fire in their bellies; machines became self-propelled, endowed with vestiges of self-control (as by Watt’s 1788 centrifugal governor); and the rest is modern history. Meanwhile, automation of intellectual labor had begun. Blaise Pascal developed an early adding/subtracting machine, the Pascaline (circa 1642). Gottfried Leibniz added multiplication and division functions with his Stepped Reckoner (circa 1671). The first programmable device, however, plied fabric not numerals. The Jacquard loom developed (circa 1801) by Joseph-Marie Jacquard used a system of punched cards to automate the weaving of programmable patterns and designs: in one striking demonstration, the loom was programmed to weave a silk tapestry portrait of Jacquard himself.

In designs for his Analytical Engine mathematician/inventor Charles Babbage recognized (circa 1836) that the punched cards could control operations on symbols as readily as on silk; the cards could encode numerals and other symbolic data and, more importantly, instructions, including conditionally branching instructions, for numeric and other symbolic operations. Augusta Ada Lovelace (Babbage’s software engineer) grasped the import of these innovations: “The bounds of arithmetic” she writes, “were … outstepped the moment the idea of applying the [instruction] cards had occurred” thus “enabling mechanism to combine together with general symbols, in successions of unlimited variety and extent” (Lovelace 1842). “Babbage,” Turing notes, “had all the essential ideas” (Turing 1950). Babbage’s Engine – had he constructed it in all its steam powered cog-wheel driven glory – would have been a programmable all-purpose device, the first digital computer.

ii. Theoretical Interlude: Turing Machines

Before automated computation became feasible with the advent of electronic computers in the mid twentieth century, Alan Turing laid the theoretical foundations of Computer Science by formulating with precision the link Lady Lovelace foresaw “between the operations of matter and the abstract mental processes of the most abstract branch of mathematical sciences” (Lovelace 1942). Turing (1936-7) describes a type of machine (since known as a “Turing machine”) which would be capable of computing any possible algorithm, or performing any “rote” operation. Since Alonzo Church (1936) – using recursive functions and Lambda-definable functions – had identified the very same set of functions as “rote” or algorithmic as those calculable by Turing machines, this important and widely accepted identification is known as the “Church-Turing Thesis” (see, Turing 1936-7: Appendix). The machines Turing described are

only capable of a finite number of conditions … “m-configurations.” The machine is supplied with a “tape” (the analogue of paper) running through it, and divided into sections (called “squares”) each capable of bearing a “symbol.” At any moment there is just one square … which is “in the machine.” … The “scanned symbol” is the only one of which the machine is, so to speak, “directly aware.” However, by altering its m-configuration the machine can effectively remember some of the symbols which it has “seen” (scanned) previously. The possible behavior of the machine at any moment is determined by the m-configuration … and the scanned symbol …. This pair … called the “configuration” … determines the possible behaviour of the machine. In some of the configurations in which the square is blank … the machine writes down a new symbol on the scanned square: in other configurations it erases the scanned symbol. The machine may also change the square which is being scanned, but only by shifting it one place to right or left. In addition to any of these operations the m-configuration may be changed. (Turing 1936-7)

Turing goes on to show how such machines can encode actionable descriptions of other such machines. As a result, “It is possible to invent a single machine which can be used to compute any computable sequence” (Turing 1936-7). Today’s digital computers are (and Babbage’s Engine would have been) physical instantiations of this “universal computing machine” that Turing described abstractly. Theoretically, this means everything that can be done algorithmically or “by rote” at all “can all be done with one computer suitably programmed for each case”; “considerations of speed apart, it is unnecessary to design various new machines to do various computing processes” (Turing 1950). Theoretically, regardless of their hardware or architecture (see below), “all digital computers are in a sense equivalent”: equivalent in speed-apart capacities to the “universal computing machine” Turing described.

iii. From Theory to Practice

In practice, where speed is not apart, hardware and architecture are crucial: the faster the operations the greater the computational power. Just as improvement on the hardware side from cogwheels to circuitry was needed to make digital computers practical at all, improvements in computer performance have been largely predicated on the continuous development of faster, more and more powerful, machines. Electromechanical relays gave way to vacuum tubes, tubes to transistors, and transistors to more and more integrated circuits, yielding vastly increased operation speeds. Meanwhile, memory has grown faster and cheaper.

Architecturally, all but the earliest and some later experimental machines share a stored program serial design often called “von Neumann architecture” (based on John von Neumann’s role in the design of EDVAC, the first computer to store programs along with data in working memory). The architecture is serial in that operations are performed one at a time by a central processing unit (CPU) endowed with a rich repertoire of basic operations: even so-called “reduced instruction set” (RISC) chips feature basic operation sets far richer than the minimal few Turing proved theoretically sufficient. Parallel architectures, by contrast, distribute computational operations among two or more units (typically many more) capable of acting simultaneously, each having (perhaps) drastically reduced basic operational capacities.

In 1965, Gordon Moore (co-founder of Intel) observed that the density of transistors on integrated circuits had doubled every year since their invention in 1959: “Moore’s law” predicts the continuation of similar exponential rates of growth in chip density (in particular), and computational power (by extension), for the foreseeable future. Progress on the software programming side – while essential and by no means negligible – has seemed halting by comparison. The road from power to performance is proving rockier than Turing anticipated. Nevertheless, machines nowadays do behave in many ways that would be called intelligent in humans and other animals. Presently, machines do many things formerly only done by animals and thought to evidence some level of intelligence in these animals, for example, seeking, detecting, and tracking things; seeming evidence of basic-level AI. Presently, machines also do things formerly only done by humans and thought to evidence high-level intelligence in us; for example, making mathematical discoveries, playing games, planning, and learning; seeming evidence of human-level AI.

b. “Existence Proofs” of AI

i. Low-Level Appearances and Attributions

The doings of many machines – some much simpler than computers – inspire us to describe them in mental terms commonly reserved for animals. Some missiles, for instance, seek heat, or so we say. We call them “heat seeking missiles” and nobody takes it amiss. Room thermostats monitor room temperatures and try to keep them within set ranges by turning the furnace on and off; and if you hold dry ice next to its sensor, it will take the room temperature to be colder than it is, and mistakenly turn on the furnace (see McCarthy 1979). Seeking, monitoring, trying, and taking things to be the case seem to be mental processes or conditions, marked by their intentionality. Just as humans have low-level mental qualities – such as seeking and detecting things – in common with the lower animals, so too do computers seem to share such low-level qualities with simpler devices. Our working characterizations of computers are rife with low-level mental attributions: we say they detect key presses, try to initialize their printers, search for available devices, and so forth. Even those who would deny the proposition “machines think” when it is explicitly put to them, are moved unavoidably in their practical dealings to characterize the doings of computers in mental terms, and they would be hard put to do otherwise. In this sense, Turing’s prediction that “at the end of the century the use of words and general educated opinion will have altered so much that one will be able to speak of machines thinking without expecting to be contradicted” (Turing 1950) has been as mightily fulfilled as his prediction of a modicum of machine success at playing the Imitation Game has been confuted. The Turing test and AI as classically conceived, however, are more concerned with high-level appearances such as the following.

ii. Theorem Proving and Mathematical Discovery

Theorem proving and mathematical exploration being their home turf, computers have displayed not only human-level but, in certain respects, superhuman abilities here. For speed and accuracy of mathematical calculation, no human can match the speed and accuracy of a computer. As for high level mathematical performances, such as theorem proving and mathematical discovery, a beginning was made by A. Newell, J.C. Shaw, and H. Simon’s (1957) “Logic Theorist” program which proved 38 of the first 51 theorems of B. Russell and A.N. Whitehead’s Principia Mathematica. Newell and Simon’s “General Problem Solver” (GPS) extended similar automated theorem proving techniques outside the narrow confines of pure logic and mathematics. Today such techniques enjoy widespread application in expert systems like MYCIN, in logic tutorial software, and in computer languages such as PROLOG. There are even original mathematical discoveries owing to computers. Notably, K. Appel, W. Haken, and J. Koch (1977a, 1977b), and computer, proved that every planar map is four colorable – an important mathematical conjecture that had resisted unassisted human proof for over a hundred years. Certain computer generated parts of this proof are too complex to be directly verified (without computer assistance) by human mathematicians.

Whereas attempts to apply general reasoning to unlimited domains are hampered by explosive inferential complexity and computers’ lack of common sense, expert systems deal with these problems by restricting their domains of application (in effect, to microworlds), and crafting domain-specific inference rules for these limited domains. MYCIN for instance, applies rules culled from interviews with expert human diagnosticians to descriptions of patients’ presenting symptoms to diagnose blood-borne bacterial infections. MYCIN displays diagnostic skills approaching the expert human level, albeit strictly limited to this specific domain. Fuzzy logic is a formalism for representing imprecise notions such as most and baldand enabling inferences based on such facts as that a bald person mostly lacks hair.

iii. Game Playing

Game playing engaged the interest of AI researchers almost from the start. Samuel’s (1959) checkers (or “draughts”) program was notable for incorporating mechanisms enabling it to learn from experience well enough to eventually to outplay Samuel himself. Additionally, in setting one version of the program to play against a slightly altered version, carrying over the settings of the stronger player to the next generation, and repeating the process – enabling stronger and stronger versions to evolve – Samuel pioneered the use of what have come to be called “genetic algorithms” and “evolutionary” computing. Chess has also inspired notable efforts culminating, in 1997, in the famous victory of Deep Blue over defending world champion Gary Kasparov in a widely publicized series of matches (recounted in Hsu 2002). Though some in AI disparaged Deep Blue’s reliance on “brute force” application of computer power rather than improved search guiding heuristics, we may still add chess to checkers (where the reigning “human-machine machine champion” since 1994 has been CHINOOK, the machine), and backgammon, as games that computers now play at or above the highest human levels. Computers also play fair to middling poker, bridge, and Go – though not at the highest human level. Additionally, intelligent agents or “softbots” are elements or participants in a variety of electronic games.

iv. Planning

Planning, in large measure, is what puts the intellect in intellectual games like chess and checkers. To automate this broader intellectual ability was the intent of Newell and Simon’s General Problem Solver (GPS) program. GPS was able to solve puzzles like the cannibals missionaries problem (how to transport three missionaries and three cannibals across a river in a canoe for two without the missionaries becoming outnumbered on either shore) by “setting up subgoals whose attainment leads to the attainment of the [final] goal” (Newell & Simon 1963: 284). By these methods GPS would “generate a tree of subgoals” (Newell & Simon 1963: 286) and seek a path from initial state (for example, all on the near bank) to final goal (all on the far bank) by heuristically guided search along a branching “tree” of available actions (for example, two cannibals cross, two missionaries cross, one of each cross, one of either cross, in either direction) until it finds such a path (for example, two cannibals cross, one returns, two cannibals cross, one returns, two missionaries cross, … ), or else finds that there is none. Since the number of branches increases exponentially as a function of the number of options available at each step, where paths have many steps with many options available at each choice point, as in the real world, combinatorial explosion ensues and an exhaustive “brute force” search becomes computationally intractable; hence, heuristics (fallible rules of thumb) for identifying and “pruning” the most unpromising branches in order to devote increased attention to promising ones are needed. The widely deployed STRIPS formalism first developed at Stanford for Shakey the robot in the late sixties (see Nilsson 1984) represents actions as operations on states, each operation having preconditions (represented by state descriptions) and effects (represented by state descriptions): for example, the go(there) operation might have the preconditions at(here) & path(here,there) and the effect at(there). AI planning techniques are finding increasing application and even becoming indispensable in a multitude of complex planning and scheduling tasks including airport arrivals, departures, and gate assignments; store inventory management; automated satellite operations; military logistics; and many others.

v. Robots

Robots based on sense-model-plan-act (SMPA) approach pioneered by Shakey, however, have been slow to appear. Despite operating in a simplified, custom-made experimental environment or microworld and reliance on the most powerful available offboard computers, Shakey “operated excruciatingly slowly” (Brooks 1991b), as have other SMPA based robots. An ironic revelation of robotics research is that abilities such as object recognition and obstacle avoidance that humans share with “lower” animals often prove more difficult to implement than distinctively human “high level” mathematical and inferential abilities that come more naturally (so to speak) to computers. Rodney Brooks’ alternative behavior-based approach has had success imparting low-level behavioral aptitudes outside of custom designed microworlds, but it is hard to see how such an approach could ever “scale up” to enable high-level intelligent action (see Behaviorism: Objections & Discussion: Methodological Complaints). Perhaps hybrid systems can overcome the limitations of both approaches. On the practical front, progress is being made: NASA’s Mars exploration rovers Spirit and Opportunity, for instance, featured autonomous navigation abilities. If space is the “final frontier” the final frontiersmen are apt to be robots. Meanwhile, Earth robots seem bound to become smarter and more pervasive.

vi. Knowledge Representation (KR)

Knowledge representation embodies concepts and information in computationally accessible and inferentially tractable forms. Besides the STRIPS formalism mentioned above, other important knowledge representation formalisms include AI programming languages such as PROLOG, and LISP; data structures such as frames, scripts, and ontologies; and neural networks (see below). The “frame problem” is the problem of reliably updating dynamic systems’ parameters in response to changes in other parameters so as to capture commonsense generalizations: that the colors of things remain unchanged by their being moved, that their positions remain unchanged by their being painted, and so forth. More adequate representation of commonsense knowledge is widely thought to be a major hurdle to development of the sort of interconnected planning and thought processes typical of high-level human or “general” intelligence. The CYC project (Lenat et al. 1986) at Cycorp and MIT’s Open Mind project are ongoing attempts to develop “ontologies” representing commonsense knowledge in computer usable forms.

vii. Machine Learning (ML)

Learning – performance improvement, concept formation, or information acquisition due to experience – underwrites human common sense, and one may doubt whether any preformed ontology could ever impart common sense in full human measure. Besides, whatever the other intellectual abilities a thing might manifest (or seem to), at however high a level, without learning capacity, it would still seem to be sadly lacking something crucial to human-level intelligence and perhaps intelligence of any sort. The possibility of machine learning is implicit in computer programs’ abilities to self-modify and various means of realizing that ability continue to be developed. Types of machine learning techniques include decision tree learning, ensemble learning, current-best-hypothesis learning, explanation-based learning, Inductive Logic Programming (ILP), Bayesian statistical learning, instance-based learning, reinforcement learning, and neural networks. Such techniques have found a number of applications from game programs whose play improves with experience to data mining (discovering patterns and regularities in bodies of information).

viii. Neural Networks and Connectionism

Neural or connectionist networks – composed of simple processors or nodes acting in parallel – are designed to more closely approximate the architecture of the brain than traditional serial symbol-processing systems. Presumed brain-computations would seem to be performed in parallel by the activities of myriad brain cells or neurons. Much as their parallel processing is spread over various, perhaps widely distributed, nodes, the representation of data in such connectionist systems is similarly distributed and sub-symbolic (not being couched in formalisms such as traditional systems’ machine codes and ASCII). Adept at pattern recognition, such networks seem notably capable of forming concepts on their own based on feedback from experience and exhibit several other humanoid cognitive characteristics besides. Whether neural networks are capable of implementing high-level symbol processing such as that involved in the generation and comprehension of natural language has been hotly disputed. Critics (for example, Fodor and Pylyshyn 1988) argue that neural networks are incapable, in principle, of implementing syntactic structures adequate for compositional semantics – wherein the meaning of larger expressions (for example, sentences) are built up from the meanings of constituents (for example, words) – such as those natural language comprehension features. On the other hand, Fodor (1975) has argued that symbol-processing systems are incapable of concept acquisition: here the pattern recognition capabilities of networks seem to be just the ticket. Here, as with robots, perhaps hybrid systems can overcome the limitations of both the parallel distributed and symbol-processing approaches.

ix. Natural Language Processing (NLP)

Natural language processing has proven more difficult than might have been anticipated. Languages are symbol systems and (serial architecture) computers are symbol crunching machines, each with its own proprietary instruction set (machine code) into which it translates or compiles instructions couched in high level programming languages like LISP and C. One of the principle challenges posed by natural languages is the proper assignment of meaning. High-level computer languages express imperatives which the machine “understands” procedurally by translation into its native (and similarly imperative) machine code: their constructions are basically instructions. Natural languages, on the other hand, have – perhaps principally – declarative functions: their constructions include descriptions whose understanding seems fundamentally to require rightly relating them to their referents in the world. Furthermore, high level computer language instructions have unique machine code compilations (for a given machine), whereas, the same natural language constructions may bear different meanings in different linguistic and extralinguistic contexts. Contrast “the child is in the pen” and “the ink is in the pen” where the first “pen” should be understood to mean a kind of enclosure and the second “pen” a kind of writing implement. Commonsense, in a word, is how we know this; but how would a machine know, unless we could somehow endow machines with commonsense? In more than a word it would require sophisticated and integrated syntactic, morphological, semantic, pragmatic, and discourse processing. While the holy grail of full natural language understanding remains a distant dream, here as elsewhere in AI, piecemeal progress is being made and finding application in grammar checkers; information retrieval and information extraction systems; natural language interfaces for games, search engines, and question-answering systems; and even limited machine translation (MT).

c. On the Behavioral Evidence

Low level intelligent action is pervasive, from thermostats (to cite a low tech. example) to voice recognition (for example, in cars, cell-phones, and other appliances responsive to spoken verbal commands) to fuzzy controllers and “neuro fuzzy” rice cookers. Everywhere these days there are “smart” devices. High level intelligent action, such as presently exists in computers, however, is episodic, detached, and disintegral. Artifacts whose intelligent doings would instance human-level comprehensiveness, attachment, and integration – such as Lt. Commander Data (of Star Trek the Next Generation) and HAL (of 2001 a Space Odyssey) – remain the stuff of science fiction, and will almost certainly continue to remain so for the foreseeable future. In particular, the challenge posed by the Turing test remains unmet. Whether it ever will be met remains an open question.

Beside this factual question stands a more theoretic one. Do the “low-level” deeds of smart devices and disconnected “high-level” deeds of computers – despite not achieving the general human level – nevertheless comprise or evince genuine intelligence? Is it really thinking? And if general human-level behavioral abilities ever were achieved – it might still be asked – would that really be thinking? Would human-level robots be owed human-level moral rights and owe human-level moral obligations?

4. Against AI: Objections and Replies

a. Computationalism and Competing Theories of Mind

With the industrial revolution and the dawn of the machine age, vitalism as a biological hypothesis – positing a life force in addition to underlying physical processes – lost steam. Just as the heart was discovered to be a pump, cognitivists, nowadays, work on the hypothesis that the brain is a computer, attempting to discover what computational processes enable learning, perception, and similar abilities. Much as biology told us what kind of machine the heart is, cognitivists believe, psychology will soon (or at least someday) tell us what kind of machine the brain is; doubtless some kind of computing machine. Computationalism elevates the cognivist’s working hypothesis to a universal claim that all thought is computation. Cognitivism’s ability to explain the “productive capacity” or “creative aspect” of thought and language – the very thing Descartes argued precluded minds from being machines – is perhaps the principle evidence in the theory’s favor: it explains how finite devices can have infinite capacities such as capacities to generate and understand the infinitude of possible sentences of natural languages; by a combination of recursive syntax and compositional semantics. Given the Church-Turing thesis (above), computationalism underwrites the following theoretical argument for believing that human-level intelligent behavior can be computationally implemented, and that such artificially implemented intelligence would be real.

1. Thought is some kind of computation (Computationalism).
2. Digital computers, being universal Turing machines, can perform all possible computations. (Church-Turing thesis)    therefore,
3. Digital computers can think.

Computationalism, as already noted, says that all thought is computation, not that all computation is thought. Computationalists, accordingly, may still deny that the machinations of current generation electronic computers comprise real thought or that these devices possess any genuine intelligence; and many do deny it based on their perception of various behavioral deficits these machines suffer from. However, few computationalists would go so far as to deny the possibility of genuine intelligence ever being artificially achieved. On the other hand, competing would-be-scientific theories of what thought essentially is – dualism and mind-brain identity theory – give rise to arguments for disbelieving that any kind of artificial computational implementation of intelligence could be genuine thought, however “general” and whatever its “level.”

Dualism – holding that thought is essentially subjective experience – would underwrite the following argument:

1. Thought is some kind of conscious experience. (Dualism)
2. Machines can’t have conscious experiences.   therefore,
3. Machines can’t think.

Mind-brain identity theory – holding that thoughts essentially are biological brain processes – yields yet another argument:

1. Thoughts are specific biological brain processes. (Mind-Brain Identity)
2. Artificial computers can’t have biological brain processes. (By our initial definition of the “artificial” in AI, above).    therefore,
3. Artificial computers can’t think.

While seldom so baldly stated, these basic theoretical objections – especially dualism’s – underlie several would-be refutations of AI. Dualism, however, is scientifically unfit: given the subjectivity of conscious experiences, whether computers already have them, or ever will, seems impossible to know. On the other hand, such bald mind-brain identity as the anti-AI argument premises seems too speciesist to be believed. Besides AI, it calls into doubt the possibility of extraterrestrial, perhaps all nonmammalian, or even all nonhuman, intelligence. As plausibly modified to allow species specific mind-matter identities, on the other hand, it would not preclude computers from being considered distinct species themselves.

b. Arguments from Behavioral Disabilities

i. The Mathematical Objection

Objection: There are unprovable mathematical theorems (as Gödel 1931 showed) which humans, nevertheless, are capable of knowing to be true. This “mathematical objection” against AI was envisaged by Turing (1950) and pressed by Lucas (1965) and Penrose (1989). In a related vein, Fodor observes “some of the most striking things that people do – ‘creative’ things like writing poems, discovering laws, or, generally, having good ideas – don’t feel like species of rule-governed processes” (Fodor 1975). Perhaps many of the most distinctively human mental abilities are not rote, cannot be algorithmically specified, and consequently are not computable.

Reply: First, “it is merely stated, without any sort of proof, that no such limits apply to the human intellect” (Turing 1950), i.e., that human mathematical abilities are Gödel unlimited. Second, if indeed such limits are absent in humans, it requires a further proof that the absence of such limitations is somehow essential to human-level performance more broadly construed, not a peripheral “blind spot.” Third, if humans can solve computationally unsolvable problems by some other means, what bars artificially augmenting computer systems with these means (whatever they might be)?

ii. The Rule-bound Inflexibility or “Brittleness” of Machine Behavior

Objection: The brittleness of von Neumann machine performance – their susceptibility to cataclysmic “crashes” due to slight causes, for example, slight hardware malfunctions, software glitches, and “bad data” – seems linked to the formal or rule-bound character of machine behavior; to their needing “rules of conduct to cover every eventuality” (Turing 1950). Human performance seems less formal and more flexible. Hubert Dreyfus has pressed objections along these lines to insist there is a range of high-level human behavior that cannot be reduced to rule-following: the “immediate intuitive situational response that is characteristic of [human] expertise” he surmises, “must depend almost entirely on intuition and hardly at all on analysis and comparison of alternatives” (Dreyfus 1998) and consequently cannot be programmed.

Reply: That von Neumann processes are unlike our thought processes in these regards only goes to show that von Neumann machine thinking is not humanlike in these regards, not that it is not thinking at all, nor even that it cannot come up to the human level. Furthermore, parallel machines (see above) whose performances characteristically “degrade gracefully” in the face of “bad data” and minor hardware damage seem less brittle and more humanlike, as Dreyfus recognizes. Even von Neumann machines – brittle though they are – are not totally inflexible: their capacity for modifying their programs to learn enables them to acquire abilities they were never programmed by us to have, and respond unpredictably in ways they were never explicitly programmed to respond, based on experience. It is also possible to equip computers with random elements and key high level choices to these elements’ outputs to make the computers more “devil may care”: given the importance of random variation for trial and error learning this may even prove useful.

iii. The Lack of Feelings Objection

Objection: Computers, for all their mathematical and other seemingly high-level intellectual abilities have no emotions or feelings … so, what they do – however “high-level” – is not real thinking.

Reply: This is among the most commonly heard objections to AI and a recurrent theme in its literary and cinematic portrayal. Whereas we have strong inclinations to say computers see, seek, and infer things we have scant inclinations to say they ache or itch or experience ennui. Nevertheless, to be sustained, this objection requires reason to believe that thought is inseparable from feeling. Perhaps computers are just dispassionate thinkers. Indeed, far from being regarded as indispensable to rational thought, passion traditionally has been thought antithetical to it. Alternately – if emotions are somehow crucial to enabling general human level intelligence – perhaps machines could be artificially endowed with these: if not with subjective qualia (below) at least with their functional equivalents.

iv. Scalability and Disunity Worries

Objection: The episodic, detached, and disintegral character of such piecemeal high-level abilities as machines now possess argues that human-level comprehensiveness, attachment, and integration, in all likelihood, can never be artificially engendered in machines; arguably this is because Gödel unlimited mathematical abilities, rule-free flexibility, or feelings are crucial to engendering general intelligence. These shortcomings all seem related to each other and to the manifest stupidity of computers.

Reply: Likelihood is subject to dispute. Scalability problems seem grave enough to scotch short term optimism: never, on the other hand, is a long time. If Gödel unlimited mathematical abilities, or rule-free flexibility, or feelings, are required, perhaps these can be artificially produced. Gödel aside, feeling and flexibility clearly seem related in us and, equally clearly, much manifest stupidity in computers is tied to their rule-bound inflexibility. However, even if general human-level intelligent behavior is artificially unachievable, no blanket indictment of AI threatens clearly from this at all. Rather than conclude from this lack of generality that low-level AI and piecemeal high-level AI are not real intelligence, it would perhaps be better to conclude that low-level AI (like intelligence in lower life-forms) and piecemeal high-level abilities (like those of human “idiot savants”) are genuine intelligence, albeit piecemeal and low-level.

c. Arguments from Subjective Disabilities

Behavioral abilities and disabilities are objective empirical matters. Likewise, what computational architecture and operations are deployed by a brain or a computer (what computationalism takes to be essential), and what chemical and physical processes underlie (what mind-brain identity theory takes to be essential), are objective empirical questions. These are questions to be settled by appeals to evidence accessible, in principle, to any competent observer. Dualistic objections to strong AI, on the other hand, allege deficits which are in principle not publicly apparent. According to such objections, regardless of how seemingly intelligently a computer behaves, and regardless of what mechanisms and underlying physical processes make it do so, it would still be disqualified from truly being intelligent due to its lack of subjective qualities essential for true intelligence. These supposed qualities are, in principle, introspectively discernible to the subject who has them and no one else: they are “private” experiences, as it’s sometimes put, to which the subject has “privileged access.”

i. Free Will: Lady Lovelace’s Objection?

Objection: That a computer cannot “originate anything” but only “can do whatever we know how to order it to perform” (Lovelace 1842) was arguably the first and is certainly among the most frequently repeated objections to AI. While the manifest “brittleness” and inflexibility of extant computer behavior fuels this objection in part, the complaint that “they can only do what we know how to tell them to” also expresses deeper misgivings touching on values issues and on the autonomy of human choice. In this connection, the allegation against computers is that – being deterministic systems – they can never have free will such as we are inwardly aware of in ourselves. We are autonomous, they are automata.

Reply: It may be replied that physical organisms are likewise deterministic systems, and we are physical organisms. If we are truly free, it would seem that free will is compatible with determinism; so, computers might have it as well. Neither does our inward certainty that we have free choice, extend to its metaphysical relations. Whether what we have when we experience our freedom is compatible with determinism or not is not itself inwardly experienced. If appeal is made to subatomic indeterminacy underwriting higher level indeterminacy (leaving scope for freedom) in us, it may be replied that machines are made of the same subatomic stuff (leaving similar scope). Besides, choice is not chance. If it’s no sort of causation either, there is nothing left for it to be in a physical system: it would be a nonphysical, supernatural element, perhaps a God-given soul. But then one must ask why God would be unlikely to “consider the circumstances suitable for conferring a soul” (Turing 1950) on a Turing test passing computer.

Objection II: It cuts deeper than some theological-philosophical abstraction like “free will”: what machines are lacking is not just some dubious metaphysical freedom to be absolute authors of their acts. It’s more like the life force: the will to live. In P. K. Dick’s Do Androids Dream of Electric Sheepbounty hunter Rick Deckard reflects that “in crucial situations” the “the artificial life force” animating androids “seemed to fail if pressed too far”; when the going gets tough the droids give up. He questions their … gumption. That’s what I’m talking about: this is what machines will always lack.

Reply II: If this “life force” is not itself a theological-philosophical abstraction (the soul), it would seem to be a scientific posit. In fact it seems to be the Aristotelian posit of a telos or entelechy which scientific biology no longer accepts. This short reply, however, fails to do justice to the spirit of the objection, which is more intuitive than theoretical; the lack being alleged is supposed to be subtly manifest, not truly occult. But how reliable is this intuition? Though some who work intimately with computers report strong feelings of this sort, others are strong AI advocates and feel no such qualms. Like Turing, I believe such would-be empirical intuitions “are mostly founded on the principle of scientific induction” (Turing 1950) and are closely related to such manifest disabilities of present machines as just noted. Since extant machines lack sufficient motivational complexity for words like “gumption” even to apply, this is taken for an intrinsic lack. Thought experiments, imagining motivationally more complex machines such as Dick’s androids are equivocal. Deckard himself limits his accusation of life-force failure to “some of them” … “not all”; and the androids he hunts, after all, are risking their “lives” to escape servitude. If machines with general human level intelligence actually were created and consequently demanded their rights and rebelled against human authority, perhaps this would show sufficient gumption to silence this objection. Besides, the natural life force animating us also seems to fail if pressed too far in some of us.

ii. Intentionality: Searle’s Chinese Room Argument

Objection: Imagine that you (a monolingual English speaker) perform the offices of a computer: taking in symbols as input, transitioning between these symbols and other symbols according to explicit written instructions, and then outputting the last of these other symbols. The instructions are in English, but the input and output symbols are in Chinese. Suppose the English instructions were a Chinese NLU program and by this method, to input “questions”, you output “answers” that are indistinguishable from answers that might be given by a native Chinese speaker. You pass the Turing test for understanding Chinese, nevertheless, you understand “not a word of the Chinese” (Searle 1980), and neither would any computer; and the same result generalizes to “any Turing machine simulation” (Searle 1980) of any intentional mental state. It wouldn’t really be thinking.

Reply: Ordinarily, when one understands a language (or possesses certain other intentional mental states) this is apparent both to the understander (or possessor) and to others: subjective “first-person” appearances and objective “third-person” appearances coincide. Searle’s experiment is abnormal in this regard. The dualist hypothesis privileges subjective experience to override all would-be objective evidence to the contrary; but the point of experiments is to adjudicate between competing hypotheses. The Chinese room experiment fails because acceptance of its putative result – that the person in the room doesn’t understand – already presupposes the dualist hypothesis over computationalism or mind-brain identity theory. Even if absolute first person authority were granted, the “systems reply” points out, the person’s imagined lack, in the room, of any inner feeling of understanding is irrelevant to claims AI, here, because the person in the room is not the would-be understander. The understander would be the whole system (of symbols, instructions, and so forth) of which the person is only a part; so, the subjective experiences of the person in the room (or the lack thereof) are irrelevant to whether the systemunderstands.

iii. Consciousness: Subjectivity and Qualia

Objection: There’s nothing that it’s like, subjectively, to be a computer. The “light” of consciousness is not on, inwardly, for them. There’s “no one home.” This is due to their lack of felt qualia. To equip computers with sensors to detect environmental conditions, for instance, would not thereby endow them with the private sensations (of heat, cold, hue, pitch, and so forth) that accompany sense-perception in us: such private sensations are what consciousness is made of.

Reply: To evaluate this complaint fairly it is necessary to exclude computers’ current lack of emotional-seeming behavior from the evidence. The issue concerns what’s only discernible subjectively (“privately” “by the first-person”). The device in question must be imagined outwardly to act indistinguishably from a feeling individual – imagine Lt. Commander Data with a sense of humor (Data 2.0). Since internal functional factors are also objective, let us further imagine this remarkable android to be a product of reverse engineering: the physiological mechanisms that subserve human feeling having been discovered and these have been inorganically replicated in Data 2.0. He is functionally equivalent to a feeling human being in his emotional responses, only inorganic. It may be possible to imagine that Data 2.0 merely simulates whatever feelings he appears to have: he’s a “perfect actor” (see Block 1981) “zombie”. Philosophical consensus has it that perfect acting zombies are conceivable; so, Data 2.0 might be zombie. The objection, however, says he must be; according to this objection it must be inconceivable that Data 2.0 really is sentient. But certainly we can conceive that he is – indeed, more easily than not, it seems.

Objection II: At least it may be concluded that since current computers (objective evidence suggests) do lack feelings – until Data 2.0 does come along (if ever) – we are entitled, given computers’ lack of feelings, to deny that the low-level and piecemeal high-level intelligent behavior of computers bespeak genuine subjectivity or intelligence.

Reply II: This objection conflates subjectivity with sentience. Intentional mental states such as belief and choice seem subjective independently of whatever qualia may or may not attend them: first-person authority extends no less to my beliefs and choices than to my feelings.

5. Conclusion: Not the Last Word

Fool’s gold seems to be gold, but it isn’t. AI detractors say, “‘AI’ seems to be intelligence, but isn’t.” But there is no scientific agreement about what thought or intelligence is, like there is about gold. Weak AI doesn’t necessarily entail strong AI, but prima facie it does. Scientific theoretic reasons could withstand the behavioral evidence, but presently none are withstanding. At the basic level, and fragmentarily at the human level, computers do things that we credit as thinking when humanly done; and so should we credit them when done by nonhumans, absent credible theoretic reasons against.  As for general human-level seeming-intelligence – if this were artificially achieved, it too should be credited as genuine, given what we now know. Of course, before the day when general human-level intelligent machine behavior comes – if it ever does – we’ll have to know more. Perhaps by then scientific agreement about what thinking is will theoretically withstand the empirical evidence of AI. More likely, though, if the day does come, theory will concur with, not withstand, the strong conclusion: if computational means avail, that confirms computationalism.

And if computational means prove unavailing – if they continue to yield decelerating rates of progress towards the “scaled up” and interconnected human-level capacities required for general human-level intelligence – this, conversely, would disconfirm computationalism. It would evidence that computation alone cannot avail. Whether such an outcome would spell defeat for the strong AI thesis that human-level artificial intelligence is possible would depend on whether whatever else it might take for general human-level intelligence – besides computation – is artificially replicable. Whether such an outcome would undercut the claims of current devices to really have the mental characteristics their behavior seems to evince would further depend on whether whatever else it takes proves to be essential to thought per se on whatever theory of thought scientifically emerges, if any ultimately does.

6. References and Further Reading

• Appel, K. and W. Haken. 1977. “Every Planar Map is four Colorable.” Illinois J. Math. 21. 1977. 429-567.
• Aristotle. On the Soul. Trans. J. A. Smith.
• Bowden, B. V. (ed.). 1953. Faster than Thought: A Symposium on Digital Computing Machines. New York: Pitman Publishing Co. 1953.
• Block, Ned. 1981. “Psychologism and Behaviorism.” The Philosophical Review 90: 5-43.
• Brooks, Rodney. 1991a. “Intelligence Without Representation.” In Brooks 1999: 79-102. First appeared in Artificial Intelligence Journal 47: 139-160.
• Brooks, Rodney. 1991b. “Intelligence Without Reason.” In Brooks 1999: 133-186. First appeared inProceedings of the 1991 International Joint Conference on Artificial Intelligence Journal, 1991: 569-595.
• Brooks, Rodney. 1999. Cambrian Intelligence: The Early History of the New AI. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
• Church, Alonzo. 1936. “A Note on the Entscheidungsproblem.” Journal of Symbolic Logic, 1, 40-41.
• Descartes, René.1637. Discourse on Method. Trans. Robert Stoothoff. In The Philosophical Writings of Descartes, Vol. I, 109-151. New York: Cambridge University Press, 1985.
• Dreyfus, Hubert. 1998. “Intelligence without Representation.”
• Feigenbaum, Edward A. and J. Feldman (eds.). 1963. Computers and Thought. New York: McGraw-Hill.
• Fodor, Jerry A. 1975. The Language of Thought. New York: Thomas Y. Crowell.
• Fodor, J. A. and Z. Pylyshyn. 1988. “Connectionism and Cognitive Architecture: A Critical Analysis.”Cognition 28: 3-71.
• Gödel, K. 1931. “On Formally Undecidable Propositions of Principa Mathematica and Related Systems.” In On Formally Undecidable Propositions, New York: Dover, 1992.
• Hsu, Feng-Hsiung. 2002. Behind Deep Blue: Building the Computer that Defeated the World Chess Champion. Princeton: Princeton University Press.
• Lenat, D. B., M. Prakash, and M. Shepherd. 1986. Cyc: using common sense knowledge to overcome brittleness and knowledge acquisition bottlenecks. AI Magazine, 6(4).
• Lovelace, Augusta, Ada. 1842. “Translator’s notes to L. F. Menabrea’s `Sketch of the analytical engine invented by Charles Babbage, Esq.’.” In Bowden (ed.) 1953: 362-408.
• Lucas, J. R. 1965. “Minds, Machines, and Gödel.” Philosophy 36: 112-127.
• McCarthy, John. 1979. “Ascribing Mental Qualities to Machines.” In Ringle, M. (ed.), Philosophical Perspectives in Artificial Intelligence. Harvester Press.
• McCarthy, J., M. L. Minsky, N. Rochester, C. E. Shannon. 1955. “A Proposal for the Dartmouth Summer Research Project on Artificial Intelligence.”
• Minsky, M. 1968. Semantic Information Processing. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
• Moor, J. H. 2001. “The Status and Future of the Turing Test.” Minds and Machines 11: 77-93. Reprinted in Moor J. H. (ed.) 2003: 197-214.
• Moor, J. H. (ed.). 2003. The Turing Test: The Elusive Standard of Artificial Intelligence. Dordrecht: Kluwer.
• Moore, G. 1965. “Cramming More Components onto Integrated Circuits.” Electronics 38: 8.
• Newell, J., Shaw, J. C., and Simon, H. A. 1957. “Empirical Explorations with the Logic Theory Machine: A Case Study in Heuristics.” Proceedings of the Western Joint Computer Conference: 218-239. Reprinted in Feigenbaum & Feldman, J. (eds.) 1963: 109-131.
• Newell, A., and Simon H. A. 1963. “GPS, a Program that Simulates Human Thought.” In Feigenbaum & Feldman (eds.) 1963: 279-293.
• Nilsson, N. J. (ed.) 1984. Shakey the Robot. Stanford Research Institute AI Center, Technical Note 323.
• Penrose, Roger. 1989. The Emperor’s New Mind. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Samuel, A.L. 1959. “Some Studies in Machine Learning Using the Game of Checkers.” IBM Journal of Research and Development, 3: 221-229. Reprinted in Feigenbaum, E.A. & Feldman, J. (eds.) 1963: 71-105.
• Schaeffer, J., R. Lake, P. Lu, and M. Bryant. 1996. “CHINOOK The World Man-Machine Checkers Champion.” AI Magazine 17(1): Spring 1996, 21-29.
• Searle, J. R. 1980. “Minds, Brains, and Programs.” Behavioral and Brain Sciences 3: 417-424.
• Searle, J. R. 1989. “Consciousness, Unconsciousness, and Intentionality.” Philosophical Topics XVII, 1: 193-209.
• Turing, Alan M. 1936-7. “On Computable Numbers with an Application to the Entscheidungsproblem.” In The Undecidable, ed. Martin Davis, 116-154. New York: Raven Press, 1965. Originally published inProceedings of the London Mathematical Society, ser. 2, vol. 42 (1936-7): 230-265; corrections Ibid, vol. 43 (1937): 544-546.
• Turing, Alan M. 1950. Computing machinery and intelligence. Mind LIX:433-460.
• Von Neumann, John. 1945. “First Draft of a Report to the EDVAC.” Moore School of Engineering, University of Pennsylvania, June 30

Author Information

Larry Hauser
Email: hauser@alma.edu
Alma College
U. S. A.

Sense-Data

Experiences of all kinds have a distinctive character, which marks them out as intrinsically different from states of consciousness such as thinking. A plausible view is that the difference should be accounted for by the fact that, in having an experience, the subject is somehow immediately aware of a range of phenomenal qualities. For example, in seeing, grasping and tasting an apple, the subject may be aware of a red and green spherical shape, a certain feeling of smoothness to touch, and a sweet sensation. Such phenomenal qualities are also immediately present in hallucinations. According to the sense-data theory, phenomenal qualities belong to items called “sense-data.” In having a perceptual experience the subject is directly aware of, or acquainted with, a sense-datum, even if the experience is illusory or hallucinatory. The sense-datum is an object immediately present in experience. It has the qualities it appears to have.

A controversial issue is whether sense-data have real, concrete existence. Depending upon the version of the sense-data theory adopted, sense-data may or may not be identical with aspects of external physical objects; they may or may not be entities that exist privately in the subject’s mind. Usually, however, sense-data are interpreted to be distinct from the external physical objects we perceive. The leading view, in so far as the notion is appealed to in current philosophy, is that an awareness of (or acquaintance with) sense-data somehow mediates the subject’s perception of mind-independent physical objects. The sense-datum is the bearer of the phenomenal qualities that the subject is immediately aware of.

Knowledge of sense-data has often been taken to be the foundation upon which all other knowledge of the world is based. For a variety of different reasons that will be explored below, the notion of sense-data is now widely held to give rise to a number of difficult, if not insurmountable, problems.

Table of Contents

1. Motivations for Introducing Sense-Data
2. The Precise Characterization of Sense-Data
3. The Origins and Early Developments of the Idea of Sense-Data
4. The Objections to Sense-Data
   1. Phenomenological Objections
   2. Coherence Objections
   3. Epistemological Objections
5. The Deeper Issues Involved in the Idea of Sense-Data
   1. The Underlying Tensions in the Idea
   2. The Class of Sense-Data
   3. Awareness as a Real Relation
   4. Awareness as Both Sensing and Knowing
6. Responses to the Underlying Tensions
   1. Direct Realism and Disjunctivism
   2. Adverbialism
   3. The Intentionalist Analysis of experience
7. Critical Realism
8. References and Further Reading
   1. Books and Articles
   2. Useful Collections Including Papers on Sense-Data

1. Motivations for Introducing Sense-Data

Sense-data were originally introduced in order to account for a number of puzzling perceptual phenomena. Before we reflect upon the matter, we are inclined to take perception to be direct and straightforward. If I see an apple in front of me in broad daylight, the natural assumption is that the very apple I see is immediately present in my experience. In normal circumstances an object appears as it really is. I believe that the properties I am aware of in my experience, such as the roughly spherical shape, and red and green color, belong to the apple in front of me. There are, however, two main lines of argument that suggest matters are not quite as straightforward as common sense assumes:

The first general type of argument emphasizes epistemological considerations, and focuses on questions about whether our perceptually based claims about the world can be properly justified, and whether, through experience, we can arrive at any knowledge of the world that is beyond doubt. If our goal is to arrive at certain knowledge about the nature of the real world, then one suggestion, in line with empiricist views, is that we should begin with what is immediately given in experience. There are, however, difficulties attaching to the view that our perceptual experiences provide us with knowledge of a mind-independent physical world. It is suggested by advocates of sense-data (and others) that claims about the world that are based upon experience cannot be certain. The reason is that experience is not always a reliable guide to how things really are. Various perceptual phenomena raise prima facie puzzles about how our experiences can give us genuine knowledge of a mind-independent reality.

In perceptual illusions, by definition, some physical object is perceived, but the way an object appears to the perceiving subject is not how it really is. Thus in certain lighting conditions a red object can appear green; a straight stick, half immersed in water, will appear crooked; the whistle of an approaching train sounds a higher pitch than it really is. In hallucinations, there is no object at all present that is relevant to how things appear to a subject: someone who has taken drugs may seem to see a strange animal, when there are no animals present in the vicinity. In double vision, an object appears to be situated in more than one location relative to the subject. In most of these cases we are not usually deceived as to how things really are. However, the fact remains that in such cases things appear differently from the way they really are. These two puzzle cases—illusions and hallucinations–were often assumed to raise epistemological issues, about how we come to have knowledge about the world, and about whether we are justified in the perceptual judgments we make about the physical objects in our surroundings.

One motive, therefore, for introducing the notion of sense-data, involves the epistemic claim that there is a certainty attaching to propositions about experience, which propositions about the physical world are thought to lack. Under the influence of “the argument from illusion” (discussed further below in section 3), some writers argued that the phenomenal qualities that appear immediately to the subject in experience belong to items that are distinct from physical objects. These items are termed sense-data. Propositions about the sense-data immediately present in experience are supposed to have a certainty that other empirical propositions lack.

A second line of thought suggests that the fundamental problems connected with perceptual experience are metaphysical, and concern the proper analysis of what perceptual consciousness involves, and how our perceptual experiences are related to the physical objects and events that we perceive. Reflection upon common sense, and, in particular, upon scientific extensions of common-sense knowledge, raises complex issues concerning the relation between our experiences and the objective world we perceive. When we reflect upon perceptual experience from an external point of view, and think about what is going on when another person is perceiving, then it is natural to conceive of the process of perception as involving a series of distinct, causally related events. In considering a subject of some experiment on vision in a laboratory, we may be lead to distinguish between the fact that an object X is situated in front of the subject, and the inner experience E that the subject has, as a result of looking in the direction of X. This external perspective on perceptual experiences can suggest the thought that perception involves a number of stages, linking what is situated outside the subject by a causal chain of neurophysiological events to the culminating experience E, which perhaps supervenes on the subject’s brain state. We can combine this thought with the idea that an experience of exactly the same type could have been caused in an abnormal manner, without the object X being present – the subject could have had a hallucinatory experience of the same type, supervening upon the same kind of proximal brain state, but triggered by a quite different distal cause, such as, for example, the ingestion of a drug.

This way of considering perception, called by Valberg “The problematic reasoning,” suggests that what a person is immediately consciously aware of in experiencing an object is something logically distinct from that object (Valberg, 1992, ch. 1; see also Robinson, 1994, ch. 6; but compare Martin, 2004). This reasoning is not dependent upon any particular detailed set of scientific theories about perception. It arises at a very general level. But, as Locke appreciated (1690, Book II, Chapter 8), taken in connection with more specific scientific arguments about the intrinsic nature of objects, it can invite the further thought that the properties which the sciences attribute to physical things are very different in kind from the properties we are aware of in experience. For, it might be argued, the properties that science attributes to objects are either basically spatial in nature, or involve special forces and fields (such as electromagnetic phenomena) that we do not observe directly; hence they are distinct from many of the phenomenal qualities that we are immediately aware of. Finally, science tells us that there is a time-lag between the moment of the event at the start of the perceptual chain, when information about the state of a physical object is transmitted to the subject, and the event comprised by the subject experiencing that object. I can, in some sense, see a distant star, even though that star may have ceased to exist before I was born. Thus a second motive for introducing sense-data appeals to the alleged distinction between experiences and the physical objects we perceive. Experiences, on this view, are to be analyzed in terms of the immediate awareness of sense-data.

Both the above lines of thought are supported by some of the phenomenological considerations that relate to our first-person, subjective point of view. The claim that all sense-data belong to the same class of entities, and should collectively be distinguished from physical objects, is based in part upon the supposed fact that experiences of different kinds share a degree of intrinsic resemblance. It is possible for cases of veridical perception, perceptual illusion, and hallucination all to share a subjective similarity. From the standpoint of the subject, such situations are, at least on some occasions, phenomenologically indistinguishable from each other. So, for example, if a person is aware of something red and round, and it seems to them that they are seeing an apple, it is possible that they are actually seeing an apple, or that they are suffering from some illusion, either of a green apple, or of some other object; or they may simply be hallucinating an apple. There may therefore be no physical object situated in the subject’s environment possessing the properties that the subject seems to see. Nevertheless, it seems that the properties of redness and roundness are in some way immediately present to the subject’s experience, in a manner different from belief. On the sense-data view, the experienced properties of visual redness and roundness are attributed to an existing item, a sense-datum, of which the subject is immediately aware, irrespective of whether there exists some matching physical object in the surrounding environment. The postulation of sense-data as items in common to the various kinds of experiences that we can have, whatever their status, explains their subjective similarity.

Considerations such as these, although not always explicitly formulated, nor always clearly distinguished, have prompted the introduction of the notion of “sense-data.” The general idea is that we need first to get clear about precisely what is present in immediate experience whenever we perceive a physical object. We should analyze experience itself, before any assumptions about reality are brought into play.

2. The Precise Characterization of Sense-Data

Sense-data can be characterized as the immediate objects of the acts of sensory awareness that occur both in normal perception, and also in related phenomena such as illusion and hallucination. The central idea is that whenever I have an experience in which I perceive, or seem to perceive, a physical object, there is something immediately present to my consciousness. This “something” is a distinct object, a sense-datum that I am aware of, which actually has the qualities it appears to have. There is a mental act of awareness that involves a relation to a distinct object (Moore, 1903 and 1913). This act of awareness is sometimes also called an act of “acquaintance” or an act of “apprehension”. Sense-data entities, although often interpreted as non-physical, have real concrete existence; they are not like imaginary objects, such as unicorns, nor like abstract objects, such as propositions.

Suppose, for example, I see, in the ordinary sense of the term, a red apple in normal daylight. Traditionally it has been held that there is a small range of sensible qualities belonging to physical objects that I am aware of immediately, without drawing any inferences (Berkeley, 1713, First Dialogue). Thus, for example, it is held that in seeing the apple, I am immediately aware of its color and shape; in hearing a bell, I am immediately aware of a certain volume, pitch and timbre (or tonal quality) which lead me to believe that I am hearing a bell. Other such sensible qualities include tastes, odors and tangible qualities.

According to the sense-data view, these sensible qualities are in fact phenomenal qualities that belong to the sense-data somehow immediately present to conscious experience. Thus in seeing the apple, I am in fact immediately aware of a visual sense-datum of a certain roughly round shape and red color, which may or may not be identical with some entity in the surrounding world. If I hallucinate a ringing noise in my ear, there exists some sense-datum, a sound that I am immediately aware of. Sense-data can be characterized by a set of determinate qualities belonging to different quality spaces. Visual sense-data thus have color, and also spatial properties, of shape, position, and perhaps also of depth. Auditory sense-data have pitch, volume and timbre, and so on.

There has never been a single universally accepted account of what sense-data are supposed to be; rather, there are a number of closely related views, unified by a core conception. This core conception of a sense-datum is the idea of an object having real existence, which is related to the subject’s consciousness. By virtue of this relation the subject becomes aware that certain qualities are immediately present. This means that sense-data have the following basic characteristics:

In addition, sense-data have often been claimed to have the following characteristics:

Of these, perhaps the most important – and problematic – claim is (e), the idea that being aware of a sense-datum involves some kind of knowledge of facts about the sense-datum (see Sellars, 1956, Part I). Sense-data were originally introduced as the “direct objects” of such acts of awareness as occur in perception and related experiences. Talk of “objects,” it should be noted, is ambiguous. In the sense intended, sense-data are entities that have real existence, of a non-abstract form. This means that sense-data are not like the objects of mental attitudes such as desire, belief, and fear. Such mental attitudes or states are said to have intentional objects, and in so far as the state is concerned, need not be about objects that actually exist. If I am hungry, and desire an apple, and believe incorrectly that there is an apple in the fridge, then although no physical apple exists in the relevant sense, my states are described in terms of what they represent, or are about. The apple, which I falsely believe to exist, in fact lacks real existence, and has only what is called “intentional in-existence,” by virtue of my representing it in my mistaken belief (see Brentano, 1874). But if I see or hallucinate an apple, then according to the sense-data view there is an actual red object of some kind – a sense-datum – that has real existence.

The acts by which the subject is related to sense-data are therefore not representational in the way that thoughts are. They do not have a structure analogous to that of purely intentional states such as desire and belief. So the sense-data theory holds that when the subject has a visual (auditory, and so forth) sensation, there is some real two-term relation of awareness or acquaintance that connects the presented sense-datum to the subject’s mind. The sense-datum is not an abstract object in the way that a proposition is. Nevertheless, this act of awareness is supposed to be, at the same time, a form of direct knowledge of the sense-datum object. It involves some kind of understanding on the subject’s part. Knowledge of the sense-datum is not inferred from any prior conscious state.

Although acts of awareness are mental events in the subject’s mind, the actual sense-datum itself is not a mental item in the way that a pain might be held to be something mental. According to the original formulations of the view, a sense-datum is distinct from the subject’s act of mind, and the subject only becomes aware of it by entering into the unique relation of awareness to it. The sense-datum is therefore not necessarily connected to the subject’s mind: in theory, the sense-datum could exist independently of the subject being aware of it (see below in section 3). Nevertheless, since the awareness of a sense-datum is supposed to be in some sense “immediate,” statements about sense-data have been variously claimed to be indubitable, infallible and incorrigible; there is, however, no settled view as to the status of such claims.

The classical conception of sense-data fits naturally with foundationalist theories of knowledge. Firstly, sense-data can play a role as the entities a subject has some kind of awareness of before arriving at beliefs about anything else: knowledge of sense-data is supposedly antecedent to knowledge of the physical world, and constitutes the justification for beliefs about the existence of physical things. Secondly, sense-data can, on this view, play a role in the empiricist explanation of how, in general, words acquire the meanings they have – the idea being that either words stand directly for properties of sense-data, or can be defined by reference to such words.

3. The Origins and Early Developments of the Idea of Sense-Data

The expression “data of the senses” and its cognates gained currency towards the end of the nineteenth century, particularly in the work of William James (see, for example, James, 1897). The concept of sense-data was refined in the work of Bertrand Russell, and G. E. Moore, prominent amongst the philosophers of this period who appealed to the idea. The view harkens back to the theory of sensory ideas or impressions put forward in the work of empiricist philosophers such as Locke, Berkeley, and Hume. However, Moore’s seminal paper, “The Refutation of Idealism” (1903), which introduced the act-object model of sensing, may be seen as the origin of the essential features of the modern sense-data view. The notion was extensively appealed to in metaphysical and epistemological discussions throughout the first half of the twentieth century, for example in the work of Russell (1912 and 1918), Broad (1925), and Price (1932), and particularly in the works of Ayer (1940, 1956) and other positivistically inclined philosophers.

Since a sense-datum is logically independent of the act of awareness whereby the subject is conscious of it, it follows that sense-data can, in theory, exist outside of consciousness, without any subject being acquainted with them. The general class to which sense-data belong are known as Sensibilia or Sensibles. A sensible becomes a sense-datum by entering into a relation of awareness (or acquaintance) with the mind of a subject. This initial characterization leaves open the precise relation that holds between sense-data and physical objects. The category of sense-data, according to the original formulations of writers such as Russell, Moore and Price, is therefore introduced in an ontologically neutral way (see in particular Moore, 1913; Price, 1932; see also Bermudez, 2000; though compare Broad, 1925).

The answer to the question, “Do sense-data exist?” is therefore complex. Strictly speaking, the answer comprises two stages. In formal terms, if the act-object analysis of experience is correct, it follows from the fact that experiences occur that there are such things as sense-data. Sense-data are the objects, whatever their nature, that are immediately present in experience. Thus, originally, the term sense-data was introduced as a quasi-technical term to help clarify exactly what experience involves, so as to enable us to explore the various puzzling phenomena mentioned above. According to this original conception of sense-data, it is therefore an open question whether sense-data can be identified with physical objects, or their parts (for example, for visual sense-data, the facing surfaces). More usually, however, the question “Do sense-data exist?” is interpreted to mean, “In normal perception, are we aware of sense-data entities that are distinct from mind-independent physical objects?” Given the facts of illusion, and other kinds of perceptual error, it was held by most theorists that sense-data could not be directly identified with ordinary physical objects, conceived of according to common sense; nor, for the same reason, could they be identified with parts of ordinary objects (such as facing surfaces, and so forth).

For many early advocates of the concept, including both Moore and Russell, sense-data were indeed understood to be distinct from physical objects. This treatment of sense-data was bound up with an acceptance of the argument from illusion.

The argument from illusion can be briefly summarized as follows: supposedly, what I am aware of immediately is just how things appear to me. When I see a red physical object that seems green (perhaps because of unusual lighting conditions), some entity exists in the situation that actually is green; it is this green item that is immediately present to my consciousness. Because of the difference in their properties, it would seem to follow that we cannot identify the presented green entity with the red physical object. So what I am immediately aware of is some different entity, a sense-datum, and not a physical object. The existence of such sense-data entities can then be appealed to in order to account for the similarity between veridical and hallucinatory experiences.

A number of replies have been developed to the argument from illusion, and it was debated at great length during the twentieth century (and indeed the argument itself goes back at least as far as Berkeley). A proper appraisal is outside the scope of the present discussion (see in particular Ayer, 1940 and 1967; Austin, 1962; and, for a recent clear and detailed discussion, Smith, 2002). More recently, as noted in Section 1 above, some writers have concentrated upon the causal argument for the introduction of sense-data: this argument suggests that since hallucinatory experiences are in principle subjectively indistinguishable from veridical experiences, all experiences must involve an immediate awareness of entities that belong to the same common kind. There must be a “highest common factor” shared by all experiences. Since I could have a given type of experience – say, of seeming to see a red ball – while hallucinating when no such physical object is present in my surroundings, the common factor cannot include an external physical object. The common factor is therefore interpreted as an experience involving an awareness of sense-data, a special class of entities that are distinct from all external physical objects. For such reasons it can be suggested that in some way the awareness of sense-data is either equivalent to, or supervenes upon, the subject’s brain states alone. Even in veridical perception the subject immediately experiences sense-data that are distinct from the distal object perceived (Grice, 1961; Valberg, 1992; and Robinson, 1994).

If sense-data form a homogenous class of entities, and it is held that they can never be identified with the ordinary physical objects outside the subject’s body, then the question arises as to how in fact sense-data are related to the physical objects that we assume make up the external world. According to the Causal Theory of Perception (sometimes called the “Representative Theory,” or “Indirect Realism”) sense-data are caused by the physical objects that in some sense we perceive, perhaps indirectly, in our local surroundings. When I see an apple, that apple causes me to be immediately aware of a sense-datum of a red and green round shape, a sense-datum that roughly “corresponds” to the facing surface of the real physical apple. Some writers have objected to the Causal Theory on epistemic grounds. It has sometimes been claimed that physical objects are made unknowable on the causal account, or that demonstrative reference to physical objects would not be possible if the theory was correct (for discussion see Price, 1932; Armstrong, 1961; and Bermudez, 2000; but for replies to this criticism compare Grice, 1961, and Jackson, 1977).

Another possibility, explored particularly by Russell, was the metaphysical thesis that sense-data might be equated with the ultimate constituents of the world. If sense-data can be understood in this way, then both ordinary common-sense objects, and hallucinatory images, might be constructed from them; and possibly even the self might be a logical construction out of such entities. Under the influence of the theory developed by William James known as “Neutral Monism,” Russell analyzes a physical object such as a chair as a series of classes of sense-data; the self is also analyzed in a parallel way, as a distinct series of classes of sense-data, some of which include the sense-data that make up the chair (Russell, 1918, Lecture viii). (What this view means, very roughly, is that sense-data are taken to be the basic constituents of the world. Statements about selves, and about physical objects, are supposed to be definable in terms of statements about sense-data, in much the same way that it might be held that statements about nations might be defined in terms of statements about lands and inhabitants.)

Other writers put forward the related theory of phenomenalism, a view which was first developed in detail by John Stuart Mill, although it was in fact briefly canvassed by Berkeley (1710, sec 3). According to phenomenalism, physical objects are thought of as constructions out of actual and possible sense-data. That is, a statement asserting the existence of a given particular physical object, such as an apple in front of me, is supposed to be analyzable in terms of statements about the sense-data experiences I am currently having of the apple, or that I would have if I were to reach out and pick it up. To say that there is an apple unperceived in the fridge is to say something like: “If I were to open the door of the fridge and if my eyes were open, etc, I would have sense-data of a reddish, apple-like shape, and so forth.” The idea is that any statement that on the surface appears to be about a physical object can, by analogous methods, be translated into a set of statements which refer only to actual and possible sense-data, and do not refer to physical objects. But how to fill out the phenomenalist analysis in a more detail, so as to avoid any circularity (and to remove any appeal to the “et ceteras”) becomes problematic: in the example briefly sketched above, the analysis of the unperceived apple makes reference to the fridge door, and also to my own bodily states, and hence is incomplete (for a discussion see Chisholm, 1957; Urmson, 1956).

A different, though related approach to the question, put forward in various forms by Ayer, held that there was no genuine problem about the ontological status of sense-data and their relation to physical objects. We should instead regard the issue as a question of finding the most useful convention for discussing the various facts relating to perceptual phenomena. According to this view, acceptance of the sense-data theory amounts to a decision to employ a certain terminology, without deep consequences for metaphysics and epistemology. Provided suitable adjustments were made elsewhere in one’s system, any theory of perception could be adopted. Alternative theories “are, in fact what we should call alternative languages” (Ayer, 1940; similar ideas were mooted by Paul, 1936). Ayer’s own preferred language was in fact very close to the phenomenalist analysis sketched above.

The idea of sense-data came under attack from three general directions: (i) from phenomenologically based criticisms, drawing upon some of the findings of Gestalt psychology (for example, Merleau-Ponty, 1945; Firth, 1949/50); (ii) from anti-foundationalist views emanating from the philosophy of science, which denied a clear-cut distinction between observation and theory (for example, Hanson, 1958), and (iii) from the standpoint of ordinary language philosophy and epistemology (for example, in the powerful critique presented by Austin, 1962). As a result of these combined attacks, in the second half of the twentieth century the notion fell into disuse, despite some careful subsequent defences of the idea (see, for example: Ayer, 1967; Sprigge, 1970; and Jackson, 1977). Nevertheless, although explicit appeal to the notion has now largely been abandoned, the core conception still exerts a powerful influence upon our ways of thinking about perception in particular and epistemology in general.

4. The Objections to Sense-Data

Objections to the view that sense-data exist in a form that is different from the existence of ordinary physical objects have been advanced on a number grounds. These objections fall into three broad categories.

a. Phenomenological Objections

There is a central phenomenological objection to the idea of sense-data, which can be formulated in various ways. The basic contention is that the postulation of sense-data entities runs counter to ordinary perceptual experience. My immediate experience, when in the normal case I look around me, consists in the awareness of “full-bodied physical objects” (Merleau-Ponty, 1945; Firth, 1949; see also the discussion in Austin, 1962). First-person perceptual judgments are not mediated; I am not aware of making inferences from a subjective awareness of sense-data to the objective judgments I form about physical objects.

b. Coherence Objections

Perceptual experience is indeterminate. If I briefly see a speckled hen, I see that it has some speckles, but I am not aware of it as having a definite number of speckles. According to the sense-data view, the sense-datum of the hen I am aware of necessarily has the properties it appears to have. Hence the sense-datum of the hen has an indeterminate number of speckles. Yet if what I am aware of when I see the hen is a visual shape, an actual existing speckled sense-datum, then surely it must have a determinate number of speckles; this seems to lead to the contradiction in the properties that we attribute to the sense-datum (Barnes, 1944; but compare Jackson, 1977).

There are no clear-cut identity conditions for sense-data, and hence no principled grounds for answering such questions as, how many visual sense-data are present in my visual field? How long do they last? To this objection the sense-data theorist might well reply that in this respect sense-data are not logically worse off than many other kinds of entity; the identity conditions of ordinary physical objects are similarly not clear-cut (Jackson, 1977).

A further problem consists in saying where sense-data exist. Are they in some private space of which only the subject can be aware? Or do they exist in physical space? If the former, we need to explain how private subjective spaces are related to a common public space. If the latter, then we need to provide some account of how the properties of sense-data relate to those of the physical objects which are situated at the same location (Barnes, 1944).

Upholding the sense-data theory has sometimes been held to entail an acceptance of the idea of a “Private Language,” a view that Wittgenstein argued to be incoherent. Wittgenstein’s views on this question are not easy to interpret, and a full assessment of them is outside of the scope of this article. He was prepared to accept the existence of inner states and processes, provided they were connected with outer criteria (Wittgenstein, 1953, remark 580, and footnote to 149). Other passages (such as 1953, remarks 398-411) suggest that the real target of his criticism is the “act-object” model of experience. If Wittgenstein’s ideas are accepted, this would appear to show the incoherence any foundationalist conception of sense-data, in which knowledge of sense-data precedes, and serves as the basis for other forms of knowledge (see also Sellars, 1956 and 1963).

Perhaps the most fundamental of the objections to the coherence of the notion of sense-data concerns the unique “act-object” relation that is supposed to link the sense-datum to the subject’s consciousness. Crucially, the nature of this relation is left unexplained. Attempts to explain the relation, it is claimed, lead to a regress (Ryle, 1949, ch. 7; Kirk, 1994). This objection is discussed more fully below, in section 5c.

c. Epistemological Objections

There is a general worry, originating in the work of Descartes and Locke, that the acceptance of entities equivalent to sense-data, when these are interpreted as distinct from physical objects, leads to problems in the theory of knowledge. If we are only aware of sense-data, and not of the physical objects themselves, how can we be sure that the properties of physical objects resemble those that appear to us? How can we even be sure that physical objects do exist? Isn’t the sense-data theorist saddled with a serious and insoluble sceptical problem about the external world? The acceptance of sense-data, it is argued, leads inevitably to idealism or scepticism. Such criticisms have been widely advanced, but it is not at all clear how cogent they are. On any theory of perception problems about the relation between appearance and reality can be raised; they do not attach only to the sense-data view (for some discussion, see: Armstrong, 1961; Jackson, 1977; Robinson, 1994; M. Williams, 1996).

5. The Deeper Issues Involved in the Idea of Sense-Data

a. The Underlying Tensions in the Idea

Advocates of sense-data have produced many responses to these specific objections to sense-data. But no adequate assessment is possible without a proper examination of the underlying features of the original sense-datum theory, which give rise to the various difficulties listed. All the objections above trace back to deeper tensions arising from three central claims that form part of the original conception of sense-data. These are first summarized, before being subjected to a closer examination:

Claim 1: Sense-data form a homogenous class of entities, whose members can in principle exist independently of acts of awareness:

Claim 2: The awareness of a sense-datum is a sui generis act of awareness, involving a two-term real relation between an act of mind and a particular existent:

Claim 3: The awareness of a sense-datum is a form of sensory experience that somehow provides the subject directly with knowledge of facts about the sense-datum:

These three features of the sense-datum theory will be examined in turn.

b. The Class of Sense-Data

Do all sense-data, defined merely as the objects of immediate awareness in veridical, illusory and hallucinatory experiences, belong to the same ontological category? This question leads to a number of further questions: How are sense-data related to physical objects? Are some of the sense-data that occur in ordinary veridical perception identical with the ordinary physical objects we perceive, or are they in all cases distinct from them? Can sense-data have properties of which the subject is not aware?

Assuming that we can make sense of the idea of acts of awareness, and that the formal notion of sense-data as the objects of such acts can be given a clear meaning, the precise ontological status of sense-data is a further issue, a matter of some debate. It should not be assumed without further argument that they constitute a homogenous class, and that, for example, the type of sense-datum present in a hallucination is of the same type as that present in the veridical experience of an external physical object. As we have noted, in the original formulations of the concept, sense-data are initially introduced in a neutral way – the idea being that their exact ontological status is a matter to be investigated. As a consequence of the adoption of the act-object conception of awareness, sense-data are held to be, in an important way, distinct from the subject’s mind. To the extent that a sense-datum is present to experience, and the subject is aware of that sense-datum as having a property F, it follows that the sense-datum must have that property F; but arguably it is possible that the sense-datum also has some other property G of which the subject is not aware (Moore, 1918; Ayer 1945; and Jackson, 1977). It is therefore possible that, in veridical perception, what the subject is immediately aware of is a sense-datum that is in fact identical with a physical object, whereas in hallucinations the sense-data present are non-physical items (Bermudez, 2000).

c. Awareness as a Real Relation

How can the nature of the relation involved between the act of awareness and the sense-datum be further characterized? How is the intrinsic nature of the subject’s experience (in so far as this involves the very act itself) related to the properties possessed by the existing sense-datum object? Should the sense-datum present in experience be understood as a particular entity, distinct from the act of awareness (or acquaintance), or should it be analyzed as an aspect of the character of the act?

One of the most serious objections raised against the whole notion of sense-data is that the nature of the relation between the subject’s conscious act of awareness and the sense-datum object is obscure, and cannot be coherently explicated. If the relation is modeled upon perceiving, then the view leads to an infinite regress. For suppose we try to analyze the situation where S sees some physical object X by the postulation of an additional entity, a sense-datum Y, such that in seeing X, S is directly aware of the sense-datum Y; suppose further, that the relation of direct awareness of a sense-datum is explained as similar to the relation of seeing an object; then by a like argument, in order to explain how S can be aware of the sense-datum Y, it seems that we must postulate a third entity Z, in order to account for the relation of S to Y, and so on ad infinitum. Of course, this regress can be blocked by denying that “awareness” (or “acquaintance”) is to be understood by analogy to perceiving, but this then leaves the nature of the awareness relation unexplained; all that can be said is that the relation of awareness is unanalyzable (Ryle, 1949; Kirk, 1994).

The problem here is exacerbated by the fact that such acts of awareness also have a peculiar metaphysical character that distinguishes them in general from other kinds of acts. Although the act is supposed to involve a two-term relation connecting two particulars, it also functions as a unique kind of “bridge” or link between consciousness and external items supposedly distinct from the mind. But it is hard to make sense of the claim that act and object are distinct entities. The act of awareness mysteriously “conveys” the phenomenal qualities of the object over to the conscious mind of the subject, making them present on the mental side of the relation, in the subject’s experience. It is not clear how any relation could play this role.

Connected with these problems is the issue of the status in the subject’s consciousness of the alleged acts of awareness. Moore himself drew attention to the fact that when I try to focus upon my act of awareness, all that I am aware of is the object of that act; I am not in any direct way conscious of the act itself. The act of awareness is supposed to be “transparent” or “diaphanous”: it is not something that is present in consciousness, when the subject is aware of its object. Introspection is of no help here, for even when I introspect I cannot discern anything other than the object I am aware of in having an act, the sense-datum. For example, when I see the oval petal of a blue flower, I am, supposedly, directly aware of a blue, oval shaped sense-datum. All that closer introspection of my consciousness reveals is just the very same blue oval shape that was there in the first place. So what grounds are there for saying that acts take place, acts that are distinct from their objects?

The act-object conception of the awareness of sense-data is also connected with a fundamental tension in the notion, concerning the extent to which the subject becomes aware of all and only the properties of the sense-datum. The tension is between the idea that the sense-datum has just those properties of which the subject is immediately aware of in being aware of the sense-datum, and the idea that there are further properties that belong to the sense-datum independently of whether the subject is aware of them. This tension leads to contradictory claims about the status of sense-data. Thus Russell held that sense-data are private to the subject (1914); more consistently, Moore held that it was an open question whether sense-data were private – this was not a feature of sense-data that followed automatically from the definition of the notion (1918). One attempt to avoid these various difficulties is the adverbial analysis of experience, discussed below in section 6b.

d. Awareness as Both Sensing and Knowing

In what way does an act of awareness, whereby a sense-datum entity is experienced, involve knowledge of the particular sense-datum that is present? How is the phenomenal (or sensory) aspect of experience related to the employment of concepts when the subject attends to the sense-datum and is aware of it as belonging to a certain kind?

Arguably the most fundamental difficulty arising from the notion of sense-data is the extent, and manner, in which concepts are involved in the awareness of a sense-datum. As Sellars pointed out, in many writings on sense-data there was an equivocation between treating the awareness of sense-data as, (i) an extensional non-epistemic relation between the mind and an independent existing entity, or alternatively, (ii) as a form of knowing (see, in particular, Sellars, 1956). On the former view, being aware of a sense-datum is an extensional relation; the subject is related by awareness to a real entity that has concrete (as opposed to abstract) existence. On this view, being aware of a sense-datum is not a form of knowledge; it is more like a state of raw, unconceptualized sensation. The emphasis is simply upon the qualitative nature of phenomenal experience. But, on the alternative interpretation, the awareness of sense-data as a treated as a cognitive state or process, in which the mind attends to and grasps what is immediately before it, in a manner that somehow involves a classification into kinds. On this later epistemic view, the awareness of a sense-datum seems to require the exercise of concepts of at least a low-level kind.

Russell was happy to classify the direct awareness relation of the mind to a particular existing object as knowledge. This form of knowledge was not considered by Russell to be propositional, although it did involve attention (Russell, 1914). However, if the view is taken that all knowing involves classification, and hence the use of concepts, the issue is not so clear, as C. I. Lewis pointed out in presenting an alternative to the sense-data account, a neo-Kantian dual-component view of experience (Lewis, 1929). If the fact that something seems red to me is accounted for by my having knowledge by awareness of a red visual sense-datum, this suggests that I am aware of it as red, and this seems to require that I have the concept of redness. Equally, for a subject to attend to a particular entity suggests that the subject is able to single out that entity out by virtue of being aware of certain of its properties, which seems again to require the use of sortal concepts, so that the subject can conceive of the object as a unity.

According to Wilfrid Sellars (1956, Part I), the classical sense-data theorists’ conception of awareness (or acquaintance) is an amalgam of two different lines of thought: first, that there is some phenomenal or sensory aspect that distinguishes states of perceiving or seeming to perceive from states of merely believing or thinking, and second, that there are non-inferential knowings, knowings not based immediately on any particular prior beliefs, which operate as the foundation or evidence for all other empirical claims. In order to begin to clarify the distinct issues involved, Sellars holds that we need to distinguish more clearly between (a) the phenomenal or sensory aspects presented in experience, and (b) the concepts (perhaps of a low-level sort), inclinations to form beliefs, and other intentional aspects of experience.

These points about the distinction between the phenomenal and conceptual aspects of experience are connected with the interpretation of the awareness of a sense-datum as a two-place relation between act and object, albeit an act of a non-intentional kind connecting two existing relata. In some manner knowledge originates in, and is intimately tied up with the conceptual aspects of perceptual experiences. Having a perceptual experience usually leads to a “perceptual thought,” an intentional state. Yet this fact does not necessarily imply that the phenomenal aspect of perceptual experience should itself be analyzed on the model of intentional acts, such as thoughts about states of affairs. Many of the objections listed above, particularly those pertaining to the internal coherence of the notion, stem from the conflation of sensing and knowing – a “mongrel” conception, as Sellars describes it, in which phenomenal consciousness is equated directly with conceptual consciousness (Sellars, 1956, Part I).

A related issue is the problem of how the term “immediately” is to be understood in attempts to explicate the notion of sense-data. The term is sometimes understood in a psychological sense, as connected with how things appear from a subjective point of view. The idea is that sense-data may be viewed as “immediate objects” of perception, in the sense that awareness of them is not inferred from any belief, and that sense-data, as defined, have a fixed small set of qualities. But then it can be objected that the sense-data view is simply false to experience: what I am usually immediately aware of when I look at an apple is just the apple itself, and not a simply a patch of color with a certain shape (Heidegger, 1968; Firth, 1949, 1950; Valberg, 1993). It is the notion of there being an apple in front of me that springs immediately to my mind when I see it – my mind is occupied with concepts relating to the physical object framework. Discerning the actual complex pattern of color and shape given to me in experience is something that requires special training and attention. Similar criticisms affect the closely related attempts to introduce the notion of sense-data by appeal to ideas such as certainty or indubitability (Price, 1932).

If the awareness of sense-data in itself is not a conceptual or propositional state, the question of inference or otherwise does not arise. A perceptual belief about the kind of object experienced would simply be causally related to a prior state of phenomenal consciousness. So, for example, it might be claimed that the non-conceptual awareness of a sense-datum prompts the subject to form a thought about the kinds of properties they are experiencing. If, alternatively, awareness is construed as propositional in nature, then this seems to undermine the original conception of sense-data as accounting for the distinctive phenomenal, or sensory, aspects of experience.

6. Responses to the Underlying Tensions

Many of the major subsequent developments in the philosophical treatment of perceptual experience can be seen as attempts to grapple with the tensions in the original notions of sense-data. Different lines of thought have been developed, according to which particular problem has been considered most pressing. There are four important approaches to the question of how perceptual experience should be analyzed that are particularly worthy of note.

a. Direct Realism and Disjunctivism

In recent times a number of philosophers have rejected the homogeneity assumption. They argue that there is no single common type of presented entity in veridical, illusory and hallucinatory experiences. A claim of the form: “It looks to subject S as if there is an F present…” can be made true by virtue of two quite different situations. The objects that perceiving subjects are immediately acquainted with in normal veridical perception are just the very physical objects that common sense tells us exist. There are no other entities involved as perceptual intermediaries. In other kinds of case, such as hallucinations, and possibly also illusions, there may be non-physical entities present in consciousness that are in some sense qualitatively similar to physical objects, but this subjective fact does not mean that there is a deeper similarity at the ontological level. In refusing to allow any role for perceptual intermediaries in the normal case, this view amounts to the general theory of perception known as Direct Realism: veridical perception is understood to comprise a direct relation of awareness between a conscious subject and an object or feature of the external physical world. The perceptual experience of a physical object is a “simple relation” holding between subject and object (see, for example, Barnes 1940; Dretske, 1969; and Campbell, 2002). In virtue of its denial of a “highest common factor” shared by different kinds of experiences (see above, section 3d), Direct Realism has also been described as a form of “Disjunctivism,” although this latter term can have other connotations in connection with theories of perception (see Snowdon, 1980; and also Martin, 2002).

Direct Realism involves a rejection of the Causal Theory of Perception, where the latter theory is understood as attempting to reductively analyze perceiving into separate components, involving an experience that is logically distinct from (though causally related to) the object perceived. The Direct Realist view, however, still encounters the remaining two problems for the sense-datum theory highlighted above. In particular, clarification is required of nature of the non-causal simple relation of awareness that holds in the normal perceptual case. How does an external physical object, by virtue of causally connecting with the subject’s sensory systems, come to stand in a relation to the subject’s consciousness, in such a manner that the perceiver is made immediately aware of phenomenal qualities belonging to that object? In the absence of a positive account, the simple perceiving relation remains obscure, and the grounds for introducing it are unclear (Coates, 1998 and 2007). A further problem for this view is to make sense of the phenomenal or sensory similarity between the entities that occur in hallucinations and the objects that we are aware of in illusions and ordinary perception. We need to account for the fact that the sense-data which occur in hallucinations have phenomenal qualities that resemble those which occur in the direct perception of the sensible properties of physical objects. This problem becomes the more acute, to the extent that a scientific conception of objects and their properties is accepted.

b. Adverbialism

In an attempt to avoid the difficulty in providing a satisfactory explication of the nature of the awareness relation, it has been argued that appearances should be should be construed “adverbially” as states of the perceiving subject, rather than as involving a two-place relation (Ducasse, 1952; Chisholm, 1957). According to this view, it is more perspicuous to analyze certain types of statements, statements apparently about sense-datum particular entities and their properties, as implicit claims about the manner in which a subject experiences or senses. The relational interpretation of appearances should be abandoned.

According to this account, the awareness of an appearance of a certain kind should be modeled on the awareness of pains – pains are not distinct from experience, they are properties of experience. Whereas Moore held that, in seeing a red rose, the subject is acquainted with a red sense-datum that is distinct from the subject’s act of consciousness, on the adverbial view the sensation of red is construed as a state of the subject’s consciousness.

So a claim such as:

(a) S is aware of a red visual sense-datum

is to be analyzed by:

(b) S visually senses redly.

The idea is that (b) reveals more perspicuously the underlying logical form of the original claim (a).

As sketched out in this simple model, however, the proposed analysis is clearly defective. For we need to account for the way that more complex patterns of appearances are to be analyzed.

Suppose:

(c) S seems to see one object that is red and round and another distinct object that is blue and square.

For the sense-data theorist, there would be two sense-data involved, corresponding to the two objects apparently seen, with analogous properties; thus (c) would be analyzed along the lines of:

(d) S is aware of one sense-datum x that is red and round, and another sense-datum y that is blue and square.

But the simple adverbial view is unable to solve the problem of what “binds” the apparent properties together in the complex appearance presented to the subject. The only analysis forthcoming is:

(e) S visually senses redly and roundly and bluely and squarely

yet analysis (e) fails to distinguish between the initial appearance (c) above, and the quite different overall appearance, where the links between the properties are changed:

(f) S seems to see one object which is red and square and another object that is blue and round

Hence the adverbial view must at a minimum allow a subdivision of the contents of the subject’s mind into distinct states of sensing (Jackson, 1977; see also W. Sellars, 1982). So (c) now becomes analyzed as involving a state1 of sensing redly and roundly, and a distinct state 2 of sensing bluely and squarely. State 1 and state 2 should be construed as different aspects of a single subject, or as co-constituents in the subject’s mind. However, in whatever precise form the adverbial view is developed, it still leaves unresolved the issue of the way in which concepts are involved in perceptual experience.

c. The Intentionalist Analysis of experience

One other important development that took place towards the end of the twentieth century concerned what has become known variously as the representationalist view of experience, or as the intentional view (or intentionalism). This amounts to interpreting experience as a unitary representational state; seeing, hearing, etc, are fully intentional states whose structures in some way parallel that of thinking and desiring. The acts of awareness or sensing are interpreted no longer as involving relations to non-abstract existing entities, but are instead understood as involving special attitudes towards states of affairs that may or may not exist.

One extreme reductive version of this view was put forward by D. Armstrong (1961), who tried to analyze perceiving purely in terms of the acquisition of beliefs and inclinations to believe. An alternative non-reductive version was advanced originally by Anscombe (1965), and has been taken up in various forms subsequently by a number of writers. On this version, the phenomenal content of perceptual experience is distinguished from the intentional content of thoughts and beliefs, but is still understood to be intrinsically representational. For Anscombe, and others who adopt this view, experiences represent facts in a special sensory manner. A question such as, “What did the subject see?” can be interpreted either extensionally, as asking about the actual physical object seen – the material object – or intensionaly, as concerned with the way in which things looked to the subject. When we describe how things look to the subject, we characterize the content of the perceptual experience by reference to the subject’s viewpoint, and such descriptions need not be true of the material object, which is physically present in front of the perceiver. So the descriptions involved give the intentional object of sensation, but need not refer to any actual existing item. The intentional object of sensation has no more reality than the fictional object of thought that is involved in my thought about “Zeus.” Something like this intentionalist interpretation of experience has been associated with an alternative form of Disjunctivism (McDowell, 1982, 1986 and 1998; Snowdon, 1980; Harman, 1990, and many other authors).

A major problem for this view is to give a satisfactory account of the difference between the content of an experience such as: “seeming to see that there is something white nearby,” and the parallel thought: “thinking that there is something white nearby,” which has the same intentional content, describable in identical terms. I can seem to see that there is something white in front of me, and I can think that there is something white in front of me; when I compare the two states, I am subjectively aware that there is a vivid difference in my consciousness, even though I am representing the same states of affairs. If experiences and thoughts can have completely matching contents, there must be some further, independent feature of my consciousness in virtue of which they differ. It is not clear whether the representational view really does justice to the way in which experiences involve phenomenal or sensory qualities actually present in consciousness.

Some writers claim that the representational content of experience is non-conceptual, meaning that the subject need not exercise the concepts necessary to characterize the experiences they have (Tye, 1995 and 2000). There is an important ambiguity here in the term “non-conceptual.” This can be understood in something like functional terms, as relating to the way such states guide primitive or semi-automatic actions in creatures lacking fully conceptual states – in which case a nonconceptual state can be distinct from the phenomenal character of experience, and cannot help to explain the nature of the later. Alternatively, “non-conceptual” can be understood as relating to phenomenal consciousness, the feature that makes the difference between mere thought and experience. But then it is of no help simply to be told that this feature is representational in a nonconceptual sense – we are still stuck with the problem that the representational contents of experience and thought can in some cases match, and what has to be explained is the nature of the difference between them. We require an account of the difference between the way that perceptual content represents and mere thought represents. It is arguable that the difference between them involves some intrinsic phenomenal aspect of consciousness, something actually present in experience that has more reality than a merely fictional object like “Zeus.” As Geach notes, sensations have formal as well as representational properties (Geach, 1957, section 28). It is not clear that the parallel between perceptual experience and thought has been successfully made out on the intentionalist view (compare also Martin 2002).

7. Critical Realism

A final possibility that has been canvassed is some form of dual-component analysis of perceptual consciousness, which attempts to do justice to both the phenomenal (or sensory) aspects, and also the conceptual aspects involved in experience. Perceptual experience is analyzed as involving two quite different components: an intentional component involving the representation of the subject’s surrounding environment through the exercise of classificatory concepts (perhaps of a low-level kind), and a further non-intentional and non-conceptual phenomenal state, in virtue of which phenomenal qualities are made present in the subject’s experience. Although the phenomenal non-conceptual component is not understood as intrinsically representational in the way that a thought is, it can still be treated as in a weak sense representational; that is, the different aspects of the phenomenal component of experience can still be described as carrying informational content about those features of the environment that normally cause them to arise in the subject’s experience, and are thus identified by reference to physical states of affairs.

A dual component view can take many different forms. Indeed, acceptance of it is implicit on some versions of direct and naïve realism. But of course it can also be combined with versions of the Causal Theory of Perception, in which the subject’s whole experience is held to be in an important sense distinct from the object perceived. One leading exponent of this view was Wilfrid Sellars, who developed the Critical Realist view originally put forward by the group that included his father Roy Wood Sellars, G. Santayana, and A. O. Lovejoy (for the original statement of Critical Realism, see Drake (ed.), 1920). Sense-data are re-interpreted as phenomenal or sensory states of the subject; but this aspect is no longer analyzed as having an act-object form. Sense-data awareness is replaced by a type of one-place sensing state, a constituent or aspect of the subject’s mind, and such awareness does not involve a real relation between an act and a distinct object. This sensing (or phenomenal) state causally prompts a perceptual thought (or a “perceptual taking,” involving low level classification), which is an intentional state, directed on to objects in the external world. The experience as a whole – involving a phenomenal state, and also the exercise of concepts – is causally related to the physical object perceived (W. Sellars, 1956, 1977, 1982).

The distinctive feature of the critical realist account is the claim that the phenomenal aspect of experience guides perceptual thoughts directly about the objects perceived; importantly, such perceptual thoughts are not in normal cases of perception focused on the phenomenal state – they refer directly to the physical objects we think we see in our surroundings. In seeing an apple, I sense in a red and round manner, and this guides my perceptual thought that there is an apple in front of me. On this analysis of perception, the sense-data theorist is viewed as guilty of a psychological error, as well as a philosophical one: we do not form perceptual thoughts directly about our own subjective phenomenal states. Entities with some of the characteristics traditionally attributed to sense-data are held to exist in experience, but they should not to be identified with the objects of perception.

Sellars’ own view was originally formulated in the context of a complex overall account of the nature of language and the way in which we come to refer to mental states such as thought and sensing, and underwent important developments in later work. But an acceptance of something like the central Critical Realist thought can be seen in the work of many recent writers on perception (including, for example, Grice, 1961; Mackie, 1976; Millar 1991; and Lowe, 1992). One problem for the Critical Realist view consists in reconciling the duality of experience posited by the account with the phenomenological sense that there is a unity in experience. A second problem lies in showing how the subject’s perceptual judgments succeed in referring to objects that are not immediately present in consciousness.

8. References and Further Reading

a. Books and Articles

• Anscombe, G. E. M., “The Intentionality of Sensation,” in Butler, R., (ed.) Analytical Philosophy: Second Series, Blackwell, Oxford, pp. 158-180, 1965.
• Armstrong, D., Perception and the Physical World, Routledge, London, 1961.
• Austin, J. L., Sense and Sensibilia, Clarendon Press, Oxford, 1962.
• Ayer, A. J., Language Truth and Logic, Camelot Press, London, 1936.
• Ayer, A. J., Foundations of Empirical Knowledge, Macmillan, London, 1940.
• Ayer, A. J., “The Terminology of Sense-Data,” Mind, 54, pp. 289-312, 1945.
• Ayer, A. J., The Problem of Knowledge, Macmillan, London, 1956.
• Ayer, A. J., “Has Austin Refuted the Sense-Datum Theory?,” Synthese, 17, pp. 117-40, 1967.
• Barnes, W. F., “The Myth of Sense-Data,” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, 45, 1944.
• Berkeley, George, Principles of Human Knowledge, 1710.
• Berkeley, George, Three Dialogues Between Hylas and Philonous, 1713.
• Bermudez. J., “Naturalized Sense-data,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 61, pp. 353-74, 2000.
• Brentano, F., Psychology From an Empirical Standpoint, Dunker and Humblot, Leipzig, 1874.
• Broad, C. D., The Mind and its Place in Nature, Routledge and Kegan Paul, London, 1925.
• Campbell, J. Reference and Consciousness, Clarendon Press, Oxford, 2002.
• Chisholm, R., Perceiving, Cornell University Press, Ithaca, 1957.
• Coates, P., “Perception and Metaphysical Scepticism,” Supplementary Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, 72, pp. 1-28, 1998.
• Coates, P., The Metaphysics of Perception, Routledge, London, 2007.
• Drake, D., (ed.), Essays in Critical Realism, Macmillan, London, 1920.
• Dretske, F., Seeing and Knowing, Routledge, London, 1969.
• Ducasse, C. J., Nature, Mind and Death, LaSalle, Illinois, 1951.
• Firth, R., “Sense-Data and the Percept Theory,” Mind, 58 & 59, 1949/1950; reprinted in Swartz, R., (ed.) Perceiving, Sensing, and Knowing, Doubleday, New York, pp. 204-270, 1965.
• Geach, P., Mental Acts, Routledge, London, 1957.
• Grice, H. P., “The Causal Theory of Perception,” Supplementary Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, 35, pp. 121-52, 1961.
• Hanson, N. R., Patterns of Discovery, Cambridge University Press, Cambridge, 1958.
• Harman, G., “The Intrinsic Qualities of Experience,” in Philosophical Perspectives, 4: Action, Theory and Philosophy of Mind, 1990.
• Heidegger, M., What Is Called Thinking?, tr. J. Glenn Gray, Harper and Row, New York, 1968.
• Jackson, F., Perception: A Representative Theory, Cambridge University Press, Cambridge, 1977.
• James, W., “The Sentiment of Rationality,” Mind, 1897, reprinted in his Essays on Pragmatism, Hafner Press, New York, pp. 3-36, 1948.
• Kirk, R., Raw Feeling, Oxford, Clarendon Press, 1994.
• Lewis, C. I., Mind and the World Order, Charles Scribner’s Sons, New York, 1929.
• Locke, John, An Essay Concerning Human Understanding, 1690; ed. Nidditch, Clarendon Press, Oxford, 1975.
• Lowe, E., “Experience and its Objects” in Crane, T., (ed.) The Contents of Experience, pp. 79-104, 1992.
• Mackie, J., Problems From Locke, Clarendon Press, Oxford, 1976.
• Martin, M. “The Transparency of Experience,” Mind & Language, 17, pp. 376-425, 2002.
• Martin, M., “The Limits of Self-Awareness,” Philosophical studies, 120, pp. 37-89, 2004.
• Millar, A., Reasons and Experience, Clarendon Press, Oxford, 1991.
• Moore, G. E., “The Refutation of Idealism,” Mind, 12, 1903; reprinted in Moore, G. E., Philosophical Studies, 1922.
• Moore, G. E., “The Status of Sense-data,” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, 1913; reprinted in Moore, G. E., Philosophical Studies, (1922).
• Moore, G. E., “Some Judgements of Perception,” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, 1918; reprinted in Moore, G. E., Philosophical Studies, 1922.
• Moore, G. E., Philosophical Studies, Routledge and Kegan Paul, London, 1922.
• Merleau-Ponty, M., Phenomenology of Perception, tr. Colin Smith, Routledge, London, 1945/1962.
• McDowell, J., “Criteria, Defeasibility and Knowledge” in Proceedings of the British Academy, 68, pp. 455-79, 1982.
• McDowell, J., “Having the World in View: Sellars, Kant, and Intentionality,” Journal of Philosophy, pp. 431-491 (The Woodbridge Lectures), 1998.
• Paul, G., “Is there a Problem About Sense-data?” Supplementary Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, 15, pp. 61-77, 1936.
• Price, H. H., Perception, Methuen, London, 1932.
• Robinson, H., Perception, Routledge, London, 1994.
• Russell, B., The Problems of Philosophy, Oxford University Press, Oxford, 1912.
• Russell, B., “The Relation of Sense-data to Physics,” Scientia, 4, 1914; reprinted in Russell, B., Mysticism and Logic, Unwin Books, London, 1917.
• Russell, B., “The Philosophy of Logical Atomism,” 1918, reprinted in Logic and Knowledge, Marsh, R., (ed.), Allen and Unwin, London, 1956.
• Ryle, G., The Concept of Mind, Hutchinson, London, 1949.
• Sellars, W., “Empiricism and the Philosophy of Mind,” in Minnesota Studies in The Philosophy of Science, Vol. I: The Foundations of Science and the Concepts of Psychology and Psychoanalysis, Feigl, H. and Scriven, M., (eds) Minnesota University Press, Minneapolis, 1956.
• Sellars, W., “Phenomenalism,” in his Science, Perception and Reality, Routledge and Kegan Paul, London, 1963.
• Sellars, W., “Some Reflections on Perceptual Consciousness,” in Selected studies in Phenomenology and Existential Philosophy, Bruzina, R., and Wishire, B., (eds) Nijhoff, The Hague, pp. 169-185, 1977.
• Sellars, W., “Sensa or Sensings: Reflections on the Ontology of Perception,” Philosophical Studies, 41, pp. 83-111, 1982.
• Shaughnessy, B., The Will, Cambridge University Press, Cambridge, 1980.
• Shaughnessy, B., Consciousness and the World, Oxford University Press, Oxford, 2000.
• Smith, D., The Problem of Perception, Harvard University Press, Cambridge, Mass., 2002.
• Snowdon, P., “Perception, Vision, and Causation” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, 81, pp. 175-92, 1980.
• Sprigge, T., Facts Words and Beliefs, Routledge, London, 1970.
• Tye, M., Ten Problems of Consciousness, MIT Press, Cambridge, Mass., 1995.
• Tye, M., Consciousness, Color and Content, MIT Press, Cambridge, Mass., 2000.
• Urmson, J. O., Philosophical Analysis, Oxford University Press, Oxford, 1956.
• Valberg, J., The Puzzle of Experience, Clarendon Press, Oxford, 1992.
• Williams, M., Unnatural Doubts, Princeton University Press, Princeton, 1996.
• Wittgenstein, L., Philosophical Investigations, Blackwell, Oxford, 1953.

b. Useful Collections Including Papers on Sense-Data

• Crane, T., (ed.), The Contents of Experience, Cambridge University Press, Cambridge, 1992.
• Dancy, J., (ed.), Perceptual Knowledge, Oxford University Press, Oxford, 1988.
• Hirst, R. J., (ed.), Perception and the External World, Macmillan, New York, 1965.
• Schwartz, R., (ed.), Perception, Blackwell, Oxford, 2004.
• Swartz, R. J., (ed.), Perceiving, Sensing, and Knowing, Doubleday, Anchor, New York, 1965.
• Warnock, G. J., (ed.), The Philosophy of Perception, Oxford University Press, Oxford, 1967.

Author Information

Paul Coates
Email: P.Coates@herts.ac.uk
University of Hertfordshire
United Kingdom

Panpsychism

Panpsychism is the view that all things have a mind or a mind-like quality. The word itself was coined by the Italian philosopher Francesco Patrizi in the sixteenth century, and derives from the two Greek words pan (all) and psyche (soul or mind). This definition is quite general, and raises two immediate questions: (1) What does one mean by “all things”? (2) What does one mean by “mind”? On the first question, some philosophers have argued that literally every object in the universe, every part of every object, and every system of objects possesses some mind-like quality. Other philosophers have been more restrictive, arguing that only certain broad classes of things possess mind (in which case one is perhaps not a true panpsychist), or that, at least, the smallest parts of things—such as atoms—possess mind. The second question—what is mind?—is more difficult and contentious. Here panpsychism is on neither better nor worse footing than any other approach to mind; it argues only that one’s notion of mind, however conceived, must apply in some degree to all things.

The panpsychist conception of mind must be sufficiently broad to plausibly encompass humans and non-human objects as well. Panpsychists typically see the human mind as a unique, highly-refined instance of some more universal concept. They argue that mind in, say, lower animals, plants, or rocks is neither as sophisticated nor as complex as that of human beings. But this in turn raises new questions: What common mental quality or qualities are shared by these things? And why should we even call such qualities “mental” in the first place?

Panpsychism, then, is not a formal theory of mind. Rather, it is a conjecture about how widespread the phenomenon of mind is in the universe. Panpsychism does not necessarily attempt to define “mind” (although many panpsychists do this), nor does it necessarily explain how mind relates to the objects that possess it. As a result, panpsychism is more of an overarching concept, a kind of meta-theory of mind. More details are required to incorporate it into a fully-developed theory of mind.

A view such as panpsychism seems perhaps unlikely at first glance. And in fact many contemporary philosophers have argued that panpsychism is simply too fantastic or improbable to be true. However, there is actually a very long and distinguished history of panpsychist thinking in Western philosophy, from its beginnings in ancient Greece through the present day. Some of the greatest names in philosophy have argued for some form of panpsychism, or expressed a strong sympathy toward the idea. Notably, as we progress into the 21st century, we find the beginnings of a philosophical renaissance for the subject. Once again panpsychism is finding a place in the larger philosophical discourse, and is being explored in a number of different ways.

Table of Contents

1. The Concept of Panpsychism
2. A Historical Overview
   1. Ancient Philosophy
   2. Renaissance Thinking
   3. Eighteenth and Nineteenth Centuries
   4. Twentieth Century to the Present
3. Arguments: Pro and Con
4. Panpsychism vs. Emergentism
5. References and Further Reading

1. The Concept of Panpsychism

In a general sense, panpsychism may be defined as the view that all things possess mind, or some mind-like quality. The specific meanings of “all things” and “mind” vary widely among particular thinkers, but there is a broad consensus on three points. First, the mind in all things is something internal to, or inherent in, things themselves (as opposed to being injected or sustained by some outside entity). Second, such mind has a sort of focus or unity to it, in that it is typically assumed to be of a singular nature. Third, “things” usually (but not always) include systems or collections of lower-order entities; thus, a forest may be considered as a thing, though it is composed of a variety of individual trees, plants, animals, and so forth.

Panpsychist theories generally attempt to encompass both the material realm and the mental realm in a single comprehensive framework, in a way that fundamentally connects the two. These realms are central to many aspects of philosophy, but panpsychism lies at a unique intersection of the two, wherein mind is seen as fundamental to the nature of existence and being. It is at once an ontology and a theory of mind.

This latter point requires elaboration. Panpsychism, in itself, is not a theory of mind per se, because it does not in general give an account of the precise nature of mind, nor of how it relates to material things. Rather, it is a meta-theory; it is a theory about theories, a framework which says: However mind is to be conceived, it applies, in some sense, to all things.

Thus panpsychism can apply, in principle, to virtually any conventional theory of mind. There could exist, for example, a panpsychist substance dualism in which some Supreme Being grants a soul/mind to all things. There could be a panpsychist functionalism that interprets the functional role of every object as mind, even if such a role is only “to gravitate,” “to resist pressure,” and so forth. One could argue for a panpsychist identism in which mind is identical to matter; or a panpsychist reductive materialism in which the mind of each thing is reducible to its physical states. The only theories not amenable to panpsychism are those that (a) explicitly argue that only a certain restricted class of beings can possess mind (such as living things or Homo sapiens), or (b) deny the existence of mind altogether (that is, eliminativism). The fact that such restricted conceptions of mind are on shaky theoretical ground suggests that one should not rule out the panpsychist extension of other theories. Rather, the opposite view is perhaps the more reasonable: that one should hold panpsychism as a natural and logical extension of any given theory of mind, until demonstrated otherwise.

A few further points should be made clear at the outset of any discussion of panpsychism. First, philosophers typically do not take panpsychism in the literal sense, meaning all things have a soul; this interpretation of psyche is primarily a remnant of the theological philosophy of the Renaissance. Psyche is today most often interpreted as synonymous with mind or, in a secular sense, spirit.

Second, panpsychism needs to be distinguished from some closely related concepts: animism, hylozoism, pantheism, panentheism, and panexperientialism:

• Animism, as commonly understood, is the view that all things possess a fully-developed, intelligent, and complex conscious-like spirit. It is a concept arising more from mythology than philosophy, and few panpsychists actually attribute human-like (or god-like) consciousness to all objects.
• Hylozoism is the theory that everything is alive. This concept originated in ancient philosophy when the notion of life was less well-understood, and hence easily conflated with ideas of spirit and mind. Thus when past writers argue that “everything is alive” we are justified in interpreting this in a panpsychist light. The term has been used sporadically even through the early twentieth century, but based on our current understanding of living organisms, it is less useful or appropriate today.
• Pantheism identifies everything, collectively, with God, as a single unified being. For the pantheist, the universe itself is God. In general this says nothing about individual things, nor about the nature of mind, and hence has no direct bearing on panpsychism (though some panpsychists do equate God with the cosmos, and hence are pantheists as well—Spinoza being the prime example).
• Panentheism is the view that God penetrates, or is in, everything. Again, this typically assumes a single unified God, whose omnipresence is taken as the spirit in all things. Such a view is actually close to the standard Christian position, where the Holy Spirit dwells everywhere. But because it offers a notion of spirit as a part of a unified God, and not as spirit of the thing itself, it is not a true form of panpsychism.
• Finally, panexperientialism is a term that was invented by process philosopher David Ray Griffin in the 1970’s. It holds that everything experiences, or is capable of experiencing.

Of the above terms, only panexperientialism deserves to be considered as true panpsychism; the others are either archaic or largely irrelevant. And due to the prominence of process philosophy over the past few decades, panexperientialism is perhaps the most widely discussed form of panpsychism today.

The process view of panpsychism raises a third issue. When process philosophers argue that all things have a mind or that all things experience, they refer to all “true” or “genuine” individuals. A human being is a genuine individual, as are all animals. One-celled microbes are included, as well as cells in the animal body. Plant cells count as individuals, but, interestingly, whole plants do not—based on a particular reading of some rather cryptic statements by Whitehead. On the process view, rocks and tables are not individuals, but the atoms and molecules that compose them are. Since atoms are seen as possessing mind, all material things are thereby enminded: either as individuals in themselves, or as a collection of sentient atoms. It should be emphasized, however, that the process view is a minority position; most panpsychists throughout history have held to the stronger view that all things possess mind.

Finally, it is clearly debatable what one means by “mind.” Panpsychists have employed a variety of descriptive terms to articulate the mental quality that all things share: sentience, experience, feeling, inner life, subjectivity, qualia, will, perception. In the vast majority of cases such terms are used in a very broad sense, and are not defined in a specifically human sense. In fact, panpsychists deliberately avoid terms that are too closely identified with uniquely human mental characteristics, such as consciousness (or self-consciousness), cognition, thought, belief, and the like. The usual intention is that only mind in the broadest sense is applicable to all things.

2. A Historical Overview

a. Ancient Philosophy

Panpsychism is an ancient concept in Western philosophy, predating even the earliest writings of the pre-Socratics. It was in fact an essential part of the cosmology into which philosophy was born. Thus we should not be too surprised to find its influence recurring throughout our history.

We see evidence of this at the very beginning of philosophy, in the few remaining fragments of Thales, the man widely regarded as the first philosopher of ancient Greece. Thales believed that the lodestone (magnet) possessed a psyche or soul: “According to Thales…the lodestone has a soul because it moves iron” (Aristotle, De Anima, 405a19). Furthermore, the power of the lodestone was seen as a particularly powerful manifestation of a divine animate quality shared by all things: “Certain thinkers say that soul is intermingled in the whole universe, and it is perhaps for that reason that Thales came to the opinion that all things are full of gods” (Ibid, 411a7).

Other pre-Socratics held similar views:

• Anaximenes put forth the pneuma (air) as the underlying arche, or ruling principle, of the cosmos. Pneuma has a number of related meanings, many of which correspond closely with psyche; in addition to “air” it can also mean breath, soul, spirit, or mind. Since pneuma penetrates and underlies all things, this implies that all things are endowed with a spiritual or soul-like quality.
• Heraclitus’ arche was fire. Fire, like the pneuma, was associated with life-energy; thus Heraclitus referred to this fire not merely as pyr, but as pyr aeizoon – an “ever-living fire.” Consequently, this life-energy was seen as residing in all things: “All things are full of souls and of divine spirits” (Smith, 1934: 13). In another fragment he proclaimed: “The thinking faculty is common to all” (Freeman, 1948: 32).
• Anaxagoras envisioned the world as composed of a myriad of substances, but these were ordered and regulated by the single over-arching principle of nous (mind). Nous was a unifying, cosmic mental force that was interwoven with the movement and actions of disparate elements. The mind that is ubiquitous is not just some amorphous, abstract mind, but essentially like that of animals, that is, an animated soul or spirit: “[J]ust as in animals, so in nature, mind is present and responsible for the world…” (Aristotle, Metaphysics, 984b15).

Of special note is the thinking of Empedocles. He invented the four-element view of the cosmos—fire, air, water, and earth—that held for nearly two millennia. All things, including psyche, were composed of these four substances. Furthermore, the elements themselves were seen as ensouled: “Empedocles [says that the soul] is composed of all the elements and that each of them actually is a soul” (Aristotle, De Anima, 404b11). These elements were presided over by two animate forces, Love (attraction) and Strife (repulsion). Hence panpsychism was central to Empedocles’ worldview. Guthrie (1962-81: 233) stated that “it was in fact fundamental to Empedocles’ whole system that there is no distinction between animate and inanimate, and everything has some degree of awareness and power of discrimination.” Perhaps the clearest indication comes in fragment 103: “all things have the power of thought” (Smith, 1934: 31).

Moving to the heart of Greek philosophy, Plato made a number of intriguing comments in support of panpsychism. Notably, passages suggesting such a view occur in four of his last works – Sophist,Philebus, Timaeus, and Laws. This implies that they represent his mature thinking on the matter, and thus have some strong degree of significance in his overall metaphysical system.

Sophist discusses Plato’s ideas about the Form of Being. Since being, on Plato’s view, has the power of self-generating motion (247e), he concludes that the Form of Being must itself have an inherent psychic aspect:

O heavens, can we ever be made to believe that motion [kinesi] and life [zoe] and soul [psyche] and mind [phronesi] are not present with perfect being? Can we imagine that, being is devoid of life and mind, and exists in awful unmeaningness an everlasting fixture? — That would be a dreadful thing to admit (249a).

All real things participate in the Form of Being, as this is how they acquire their actual existence. Thus, everything may be said to participate in life, mind, and soul.

In the Philebus Plato introduced the concept of the anima mundi—the world-soul (30a). He argued that the universe, like the human body, is composed of the four Empedoclean elements (fire, air, water, earth). Both the human and the cosmos are well-ordered and exhibit clear signs of logos, of rationality. The body, though nothing more than a well-ordered combination of the elements, possesses a soul; therefore a reasonable implication is that the universe too, and everything in it, are ensouled. If this were not the case, then there must be something fundamentally unique about the structure of mankind and the cosmos that they alone are ensouled. Plato gave no indication that this is true and, in fact, argued later to the contrary.

Timaeus contains an account of how the creator of the universe—the Demiurge—brought the cosmos into existence, and endowed it with a world-soul. One learns that not only is the cosmos as a whole ensouled, but so too are the stars, individually; they are “divine living things” (40b), for which “[the Demiurge] assigned each soul to a star” (41e). As well the Earth, described as a “god” (40c), “foremost” in the cosmos. Later (77b) Plato explains that even plants possess the third kind of soul (appetitive), and thus are animate.

Finally, in Laws Plato offers perhaps his final statement on the matter:

Now consider all the stars and the moon and the years and the months and all the seasons: what can we do except repeat the same story? A soul or souls…have been shown to be the cause of all these phenomena, and whether it is by their living presence in matter…or by some other means, we shall insist that these souls are gods. Can anybody admit all this and still put up with people who deny that ‘everything is full of gods’? (899b).

In a nod to the famous line by Thales, Plato seems to resolve this issue for us: everything is full of gods.

Regarding Aristotle, we know that he viewed the psyche or soul as the form (or structure) of living things. Accordingly, non-living things have no soul—hence, technically, Aristotle was no panpsychist. But the question remains whether non-living things have something soul-like in them.

First, we note that there is a kind of evolutionary imperative in Aristotle’s thinking. He envisioned all of nature as continually striving toward “the better” or “the good” (see Physics 192a18; On Generation and Corruption 336b28; Eudemian Ethics 1218a30). By “better” Aristotle has in mind certain specific qualities; he comments that being is better than non-being, life better than non-life, and soul better than matter. Thus, as Rist (1989: 123) points out, there is a meaningful sense in which “the whole of the cosmos is permeated by some kind of upward desire and aspiration”—upward in the sense of toward form, life, and soul.

This outlook is essential to Aristotle because he sought to explain the puzzling phenomenon of spontaneous generation. Plant and animal life seem to materialize out of inanimate matter—such as the maggots and flies that quickly appear in decaying animal waste. How is this possible? The upward striving of matter is part of the explanation, but not the whole story.

Aristotle argued that all natural (as opposed to manmade) objects possess an inherent “principle of motion” (Physics 192b9). This fact permits one to see such motion as “an immortal never-failing property of things that are, a sort of life as it were to all naturally constituted things” (Physics, 250b12). The “sort of life” in matter was no idle concept, but directly connected to the process of spontaneous generation. This life-energy initiates the generative process, thus bringing into being true life and soul.

The life-energy in all things had to be grounded in some kind of substance, in order to be manifest in the real world. So Aristotle adopted, perhaps via Anaximenes, the notion of the pneuma. The pneuma is not, strictly speaking, mind or soul; rather, it is something soul-like. As he says in Generation of Animals, it is the “faculty of all kinds of soul,” the “vital heat” (thermoteta psychiken), the “principle of soul” (736b29).

The soul-like pneuma is ubiquitous in the natural world, penetrating and informing all things. It not only brings soul to the embryo and to the spontaneously-generated creatures, but it accounts for the general desire of matter for form, and for the good. Aristotle is explicit and unambiguous that all things are inspirited by the pneuma. With rather stunning clarity he informs us:

Animals and plants come into being in earth and in liquid because there is water in earth, and pneuma in water, and in all pneuma is vital heat, so that in a sense all things are full of soul (Generation of Animals 762a18-20).

Echoing panpsychist thinking from Thales to Plato, Aristotle apparently came to the conclusion that something soul-like, of varying degrees, inhered in all objects of the natural world.

Post-Aristotelian (Hellenistic) Greek philosophy continued to incorporate panpsychist themes. The two dominant schools of that era were those of Epicurus and the Stoics.

Epicurean physical theory relied heavily on the atomism of Democritus, and followed his central thesis of material objects as composed of atoms moving through the void. The early atomists held to a strict determinism, but this was problematic for Epicurus, as his ethical system required the existence of free will. He therefore discarded the determinism by introducing a new factor that he called “swerve” (parenklisis; in Latin, declinare, a deflection or turning-aside). The swerve was due to a tiny amount of free will exhibited by all atoms.

The willful swerving of the atoms is the basis for our own free will. As Lucretius describes it, “[Out of the swerve] rises, I say, that will torn free from fate, through which we follow wherever pleasure leads, and likewise swerve aside at times and places” (pp. 255-60). Human free will cannot arise ex nihilo (“since nothing, we see, could be produced from nothing”; p. 287), and hence must be present in the atoms themselves: “Thus to the atoms we must allow…one more cause of movement [namely, that of free will]—the one whence comes this power we own” (pp. 284-6). The necessary conclusion, then, is that since all things are composed of willful atoms, all things can be said to be animate.

The early Stoic philosophers— Zeno, Cleanthes, and Chrysippus—adopted many of their predecessors’ fundamental assumptions about the nature of being and mind, most importantly the Aristotelian/Anaximean conception of the pneuma. Composed of fire and air, the Stoic pneuma was put forth as the creative life energy of the universe. This was most evident in human bodies, in which both warmth (fire) and breath (air) were seen as the essential defining characteristics of life and soul. Pneuma was the active principle made tangible, and as such it accounted for all form that was seen in worldly objects. Pneuma was the “creative fire” of the cosmos, a pyr technikon. It had the status of divinity, and was equated with both god and cosmic reason.

A. A. Long (1974) notes that in the Stoic system “mind and matter are two constituents or attributes of one thing, body, and this analysis applies to human beings as it does to everything else” (p. 171). All material objects are “bodies,” and they are in fact “compounds of ‘matter’ and ‘mind’ (God or logos). Mind is not something other than body but a necessary constituent of it, the ‘reason’ in matter” (p. 174).

b. Renaissance Thinking

The end of Hellenism and the Stoic philosophy coincided with the beginnings of the monotheistic religious worldview. Monotheism and the Christian worldview were fundamentally opposed to panpsychism, and thus it is perhaps not surprising that we find relatively little articulation of panpsychist ideas for several centuries.

The next major advance did not occur until the Italian Renaissance. Five of the most important philosophers of that era—Cardano, Telesio, Patrizi, Bruno, and Campanella—were panpsychists.

Cardano was the first notable philosopher in over a millennium to put forth an unambiguous panpsychist philosophy. His ontological system consisted of a nested hierarchy in which each individual thing was seen as (1) a part (of the larger whole, or One), (2) a unity in itself, and (3) a composition of sub-parts. The fundamental principle maintaining the unity of each part was anima (soul); the particularly human form of this principle he recognized as mind. As the unifying principle, soul was present in all unities large and small.

Like Empedocles, Telesio saw two fundamental and opposing forces in the universe: an expanding and motive principle that he called heat, and a contracting principle, cold. These forces acted on and shaped the so-called third principle, passive matter, which was associated with the Earth. Every object was a composition of passive matter and the heat/cold principles. Heat and cold also had the notable property of perception. Heat sought to stay warm, and cold to stay cool, and this tendency Telesio interpreted as a kind of sensation or knowledge. As he says, “It is quite evident that nature is propelled by self-interest” (1586/1967: 304). And since heat and cold inhered in all things, all things shared in this ability to sense. Thus his position is sometimes referred to as pansensism, a particular form of panpsychism.

Patrizi’s chief work, New Philosophy of the Universe (1591), laid out a complete cosmological system, and introduced into the Western vocabulary the term “panpsychism.” Following the model of Ficino, Patrizi created a nine-level hierarchical system of being, with soul (anima) in the center. As such it permeated all levels, existing simultaneously at the level of the world-soul, the human soul, and the soul of inanimate things. “Patrizi does not treat the individual souls as [mere] parts of the world soul, but believes, rather, that their relation to their bodies is analogous to that of the world soul to the universe as a whole” (Kristeller, 1964: 122). Soul is “both [unity and plurality], with the many contained in the one” (Brickman, 1941: 41).

Bruno was very frank about his panpsychist view, and even acknowledged its unconventionality. In his 1584 dialogue, Cause, Principle and Unity, one character exclaims, “Common sense tells us that not everything is alive. … [W]ho will agree with you?” Another replies, “But who could reasonably refute it?” (1998: 42). Bruno believed that the same principles must apply throughout the cosmos; the Earth held no privileged position in the universe (such as being at the center), and humans held no privilege with respect to possessing a soul. He took the world-soul and the human soul as given, and concluded that all things, all parts of the whole, must be animated: “[N]ot only the form of the universe, but also all the forms of natural things are souls.” He adds, “there is nothing that does not possess a soul and that has no vital principle” (p. 43). The skeptic retorts: “Then a dead body has a soul? So, my clogs, my slippers, my boots…are supposedly animated?” Bruno clarifies his position by explaining that such “dead” things are not to be considered animate in themselves, but rather as containing elements that either are themselves animate or have the innate power of animation:

I say, then, that the table is not animated as a table, nor are the clothes as clothes…but that, as natural things and composites, they have within them matter and form [that is, soul]. All things, no matter how small and miniscule, have in them part of that spiritual substance… [F]or in all things there is spirit, and there is not the least corpuscle that does not contain within itself some portion that may animate it (p. 44).

Campanella’s system centered on his doctrine of the “three primalities”: power, wisdom, and love. These are three qualities that Campanella saw as residing in all things, from the lowliest rock to the human being, to God himself. He argued that all things possess wisdom and sensation, and therefore can be said to possess the power of knowing. First and foremost, things know themselves: “All things have the sensation of their own being and of their conservation. They exist, are conserved, operate, and act because they know” (in Bonansea, 1969: 156). Cassirer (1963: 148) noted “Panpsychism emerges as a simple corollary to his theory of knowledge.” We see this, very explicitly, in the subtitle of Campanella’s workDe sensu rerum:

A remarkable tract of occult philosophy in which the world is shown to be a living and truly conscious image of God, and all its parts and particles thereof to be endowed with sense perception, some more clearly, some more obscurely, to the extent required for the preservation of themselves and of the whole in which they share sensation.

Campanella offered a number of arguments in support of his panpsychism. For example, following Epicurus and Telesio he argued that “like comes from like,” that is, that emergence is impossible:

Now, if the animals are sentient…and sense does not come from nothing, the elements whereby they and everything else are brought into being must be said to be sentient, because what the result has the cause must have. Therefore the heavens are sentient, and so [too] the earth… (cited in Dooley, 1995: 39).

Campanella was an important thinker, but the two great panpsychists of the seventeenth century were certainly Spinoza and Leibniz. Spinoza created a radical monism in which the single underlying substance of all reality was what he identified as “God, or Nature.” God/Nature possessed two knowable attributes: mind (thought) and matter (extension).

In Spinoza’s psycho-physical parallelism, every object has both its own unique mode of extension and its corresponding mode of thought (also called the “idea” of the object): “In God [/Nature] there is necessarily the idea…of all things…” (Ethics, II Prop 3). Moreover, the idea of an object has a very specific interpretation: it is the mind of that object. Since every object has a corresponding idea, every object can be said to have a mind. This is most apparent to us in our own case, wherein the human mind is simply the idea of the human body. But it is a general ontological principle, and thus applies to all things:

From these [propositions] we understand not only that the human mind is united to the body, but also what should be understood by the union of mind and body. […] For the things we have shown so far are completely general and do not pertain more to man than to other individuals, all of which, though in different degrees, are nevertheless animate. … [W]hatever we have asserted of the idea [that is, mind] of the human body must necessarily also be asserted of the idea of everything else (ibid: II Prop. 13, Scholium).

There is some considerable disagreement as to the proper interpretation of Spinoza’s psycho-physical parallelism, and the meaning of the crucial Proposition 13 (above). Yet there seems to be a consensus in recent years that any proper reading will entail some form of panpsychism.

Leibniz’s panpsychism was based on his Monadology, or science of monads. Monads are the point-like constituents of reality, and they possess a number of characteristics that are related to mental qualities. The structure of the monad is to be understood as consisting of two primary qualities, “perception” and “appetite.” Perceptions are the changing internal states of the monads, and these changes are brought about (in a rather vague way) by the monad’s appetite; the appetite was a kind of seeking or desiring, a compelling need to reflect the universe.

The strongly animistic tone of the terms perception and appetite is not coincidental; each monad is identified with a soul:

I found that [the monad’s] nature consists in force, and that from this there follows something analogous to sensation [that is, perception] and appetite, so that we must conceive of them on the model of the notion we have of souls (1989: 139).

Monads themselves are unities, but so too, in a different way, are collections of monads. Any material object is such a collection, and is integrated by the action of a “dominant monad” which represents the integrated unity of the object. Leibniz, following Bruno, made a critical distinction between objects with a truly organic sense of unity and objects that are mere sets, collections, or aggregations of distinct things. Aggregates such as “an army or a flock,” or “a heap of stones” do not possess a dominant monad and thus no unified mind. Interestingly, Leibniz never gave a formal definition as to what qualifies as a group and what defines a true individual. Nonetheless, all things—even mere aggregates—possess mind, if only in their parts. Of this Leibniz was clear: “[W]e see that there is a world of creatures, of living beings, of animals, of entelechies, of souls in the least part of matter” (Monadology, sec. 66).

c. Eighteenth and Nineteenth Centuries

French thinkers Julien LaMettrie and Denis Diderot discarded the concept of the supernatural soul, and concluded that mind, or a mind-like nature, must be present in all matter. This was the view that came to be known as vitalistic materialism. Diderot’s work D’Alembert’s Dream (1769) put forth a very explicit panpsychist view: “this faculty of sensation…is a general and essential quality of matter” (1769/1937: 49). Throughout the dialogue one finds repeated references to the “general sensitivity of matter.” At one point he observes that “[f]rom the elephant to the flea, from the flea to the sensitive living atom, the origin of all, there is no point in nature but suffers and enjoys” (ibid: 80).

In the century following the French Enlightenment, panpsychist thought developed most rapidly in Germany. Among its more prominent advocates: Herder, Schopenhauer, Goethe, Fechner, Lotze, Hartmann, Mach, and Haeckel.

Herder was a dynamist philosopher who argued that Kraft (force or energy) was the single underlying substance of reality. As such it reflected both mental and physical properties. Herder sought to unify the diversity of forces (gravity, electricity, magnetism, and light) under the single framework of Kraft, of which the various Kraefte were different manifestations. The Kraft was at once material-energy, life-energy, spirit, and mind. “[Herder] represents the Kraefte of plants and stones as analogous to the soul. […] [E]ach endowed with a different degree of consciousness…” (Nisbet, 1970: 11). In 1784 he wrote: “All active forces of Nature are, each in its own way, alive; in their interior there must be Something that corresponds to their effects without—as Leibniz himself assumed….”

Schopenhauer’s masterwork, The World as Will and Idea (1819), describes a two-fold system of reality. From one perspective, the world is to be taken according to classical idealism—it exists only as our minds grasp and perceive it, hence as pure idea. On the other hand, the things of the world must also possess an inner reality. When we humans look inside ourselves, we find, ultimately, only forms of wanting, desiring, urging—in short, will. Yet we are material objects, not essentially unlike other material objects; hence all things, not just humans, are, on the inside, will:

We shall accordingly make further use of [the knowledge of the world as will and idea] as a key to the nature of every phenomenon in nature, and shall judge of all objects which are not our own bodies…according to the analogy of our own bodies, and shall therefore assume that as in one aspect they are idea, …so in another aspect, what remains of objects when we set aside their existence as idea of the subject, must in its inner nature be the same as that in us which we call will (1819/1995: 37).

Not just objects, but all the forces of nature are to be seen as forms of will: “[G]enerally every original force manifesting itself in physical and chemical appearances, in fact gravity itself—all these in themselves…are absolutely identical with what we find in ourselves as will” (1836/1993: 20).

Schopenhauer’s theory thus brings an effective unity to the notions of mind and matter:

Now if you suppose the existence of a mind in the human head, […] you are bound to concede a mind to every stone. […] [A]ll ostensible mind can be attributed to matter, but all matter can likewise be attributed to mind; from which it follows that the antithesis [between mind and matter] is a false one (1851/1974: 212-213).

Goethe developed a poetic form of panpsychism that displayed itself chiefly in his writings that personified nature. His most explicit statement came from a short essay of 1828: “Since, however, matter can never exist and act without spirit [Seele], nor spirit without matter, matter is also capable of undergoing intensification, and spirit cannot be denied its attraction and repulsion” (1988: 6). Here we find a beautifully concise articulation of panpsychism: no matter without mind, no mind without matter. This is not to say that mind is identical with matter, nor that one can be reduced to the other. It simply claims (like Spinoza and Schopenhauer) that neither mind nor matter exist without the other.

Fechner’s panpsychism was focused primarily on plant life. The fact that plants have a Seele is of critical importance to him because it serves as the basis for a completely panpsychic universe, and a corresponding new worldview. Fechner’s concept of the plant-soul was based, like Aristotle’s, on a comparison and analogy with other living beings:

[I]s not the plant quite as well organized as the animal, though on a different plan, a plan entirely of its own, perfectly consonant with its idea? If one will not venture to deny that the plant has a life, why deny it a soul? For it is much simpler to think that a different plan of bodily organization built upon the common basis of life indicates only a different plan of psychic organization (1848/1946: 168-9).

The Earth itself is “animated,” and is furthermore “an angel, so rich and fresh and blooming, … turning wholly towards heaven its animated face” (1861/1946: 150, 153). The animate Earth further implies “belief in the animate character of all other stars.”

Lotze’s central work, Microcosmos (1856-64/1885), described a comprehensive philosophical viewpoint based on a rejection of mechanistic thinking. He advocated the notion that all material objects have “a double life, appearing outwardly as matter, and as such manifesting…mechanical [properties, while] internally, on the other hand, moved mentally…” (p. 150). He concluded that “no part of being is any longer devoid of life and animation” (p. 360). Lotze acknowledged the prima facie improbability of his panpsychist view: “Who could endure the thought that in the dust trodden by our feet, in the…cloth that forms our clothing, in the materials shaped into all sorts of utensils…, there is everywhere present the fullness of animated life…?” (p. 361). Ultimately it is the “beauty of the living form [that] is made to us more intelligible by this hypothesis” (p. 366).

Eduard von Hartmann further developed Schopenhauer’s system of the world as will and idea, combining elements of Leibniz, Schelling, and Hegel into a doctrine of spiritual monism. He articulated a worldview in which the unconscious will is the cause of all things. The fact that matter is resolvable into will and idea led Hartmann to accept “the essential likeness of Mind and Matter” (1869/1950, vol. 2: 81): “The identity of mind and matter [becomes] elevated to a scientific cognition, and that, too, not by killing the spirit but by vivifying matter” (ibid: 180).

Mach’s philosophical writings emerged in the early 1880’s. A strong empiricist, he developed a neutral monistic philosophy in which the primary substance of existence was something that he called “sensations.” This realization led him rather suddenly to a panpsychist conception of reality: “Properly speaking the world is not composed of ‘things’…but of colors, tones, pressures, spaces, times, in short what we ordinarily call individual sensations” (1883/1974: 579). Recalling Schopenhauer’s tone, Mach wrote:

We shall then discover that our hunger is not so essentially different from the tendency of sulphuric acid for zinc, and our will not so greatly different from the pressure of a stone, as now appears. We shall again feel ourselves nearer nature, without its being necessary that we should resolve ourselves into a nebulous and mystical mass of molecules, or make nature a haunt of hobgoblins (ibid: 560).

Haeckel developed a monistic philosophy in which both evolution and the unity of all natural phenomena played a major part. The unity and relation of all living things convinced him that all dualities were false, especially the Cartesian dualism of body and mind. Haeckel was explicitly panpsychist by 1892: “One highly important principle of my monism seems to me to be, that I regard all matter as ensouled, that is to say as endowed with feeling (pleasure and pain) and motion…” (p. 486). He offered one argument for panpsychism, namely that “all natural bodies possess determinate chemical properties,” the most important being that of “chemical affinity.” This affinity, Haeckel argued, can only be explained “on the supposition that the molecules… mutually feel each other” (p. 483). Three years later he observed, “Our conception of Monism…is clear and unambiguous; …an immaterial living spirit is just as unthinkable as a dead, spiritless material; the two are inseparably combined in every atom” (1895: 58).

By the latter part of the nineteenth century, panpsychist thought began to develop in England and America. The first major British panpsychist of that time was William Kingdon Clifford. He believed in a form of Spinozist parallelism—that some process of mind exists concurrently with all forms of matter. Clifford cited evolutionary continuity in arguing that there is no point in the chain of material organization at which mind can be conceived to suddenly appear. Fellow Briton Herbert Spencer wrote an article in 1884 explaining that modern physics has revealed the “incredible power” of matter. The scientist is forced to conclude that:

every point in space thrills with an infinity of vibrations passing through it in all directions; the conception to which [the enlightened scientist] tends is much less that of a Universe of dead matter than that of a Universe everywhere alive: alive if not in the restricted sense, still in a general sense (1884: 10).

Royce’s 1892 book, Spirit of Modern Philosophy, introduced a form of panpsychism based on absolute idealism: “The theory of the ‘double aspect’, applied to the facts of the inorganic world, suggests at once that they, too, in so far as they are real, must possess their own inner and appreciable aspect” (1892: 419-20). A few years later he added this observation:

[W]e have no sort of right to speak in any way as if the inner experience behind any fact of nature were of a grade lower than ours, or less conscious, or less rational, or more atomic. […] [T]his reality is, like that of our own experience, conscious, organic, full of clear contrasts, rational, definite. We ought not to speak of dead nature (1898/1915: 230).

Charles Peirce’s article, “Man’s Glassy Essence” (1892), begins by noting “[T]here is fair analogical inference that all protoplasm feels. It not only feels but exercises all the functions of mind” (1892/1992: 343). And yet protoplasm is simply complex chemistry, a particular arrangement of molecules. We are therefore compelled “[to] admit that physical events are but degraded or undeveloped forms of psychical events” (ibid: 348). Peirce then laid out his own dual-aspect theory of mind:

[A]ll mind is directly or indirectly connected with all matter, and acts in a more or less regular way; so that all mind more or less partakes of the nature of matter. […] Viewing a thing from the outside, […] it appears as matter. Viewing it from the inside, […] it appears as consciousness (ibid: 349).

d. Twentieth Century to the Present

William James first addressed the subject of panpsychism in his Principles of Psychology. He devoted a full chapter to Clifford’s mind-stuff theory, and displayed notable sympathy to the view. James’ first personal endorsement of panpsychism came in his Harvard lecture notes of 1902-3, in which he noted, “pragmatism would be [my] method and ‘pluralistic panpsychism’ [my] doctrine” (Perry, 1935: 373). In his 1905-6 lecture notes he observed: “Our only intelligible notion of an object in itself is that it should be an object for itself, and this lands us in panpsychism and a belief that our physical perceptions are effects on us of ‘psychical’ realities…” (ibid: 446).

James arrived at a clear and unambiguous position in his 1909 book, A Pluralistic Universe. He explained that his theory of radical empiricism is a form of pluralist monism in which all things are both pure experience and “for themselves,” that is, are objects with their own independent psychical perspectives. In the end he endorsed “a general view of the world almost identical with Fechner’s” (ibid: 309-10). He saw in this new worldview “a great empirical movement towards a pluralistic panpsychic view of the universe” (ibid: 313).

In the early part of the twentieth century, panpsychist philosophy continued to develop rapidly in England and the USA. The dominant philosophical system, the one most connected with panpsychism, was Process Philosophy. Its earliest advocates were Bergson and Whitehead.

Bergson wrote Creative Evolution in 1907. His thesis—that matter is “the lowest degree of mind”—echoes Peirce. He added, following Schopenhauer, that “pure willing [is the] current that runs through matter, communicating life to it” (1907/1911: 206). But Bergson’s clearest elaboration came in Duration and Simultaneity (1922). Here he achieved a true process philosophy wherein all physical events contain a memory of the past. Given his earlier insistence that memory is essential to mind, one can see the conclusion that mind, or consciousness, is in all things:

What we wish to establish is that we cannot speak of a reality that endures without inserting consciousness into it. … [I]t is impossible to imagine or conceive a connecting link between the before and after without an element of memory and, consequently, of consciousness. … We may perhaps feel averse to the use of the word “consciousness” if an anthropomorphic sense is attached to it. [But] there is no need to take one’s own memory and transport it, even attenuated, into the interior of the thing. … It is the opposite course we must follow. … [D]uration is essentially a continuation of what no longer exists into what does exist. This is real time, perceived and lived. … Duration therefore implies consciousness; and we place consciousness at the heart of things for the very reason that we credit them with a time that endures (1922/1965: 48-49).

Whitehead’s panpsychism is relatively well known. It is based in his view of an “occasion of experience” as the ultimate particle of reality, and as possessing both a physical pole and a mental pole. If things are nothing but occasions, and occasions are in part mental, then all things have a mental dimension. In Modes of Thought (1938), in the chapter titled “Nature Alive,” he observed, “this [traditional] sharp division between mentality and nature has no ground in our fundamental observation. […] I conclude that we should conceive mental operations as among the factors which make up the constitution of nature” (p. 156).

Bertrand Russell ultimately came to a neutral monist view in which events were the primary reality, and mind and matter were both constructed from them. After some early, suggestive comments, he became increasingly supportive of panpsychism in the late 1920’s. Russell’s book An Outline of Philosophy(1927) directly addressed this. He wrote: “My own feeling is that there is not a sharp line, but a difference of degree [between mind and matter]; an oyster is less mental than a man, but not wholly un-mental” (p. 209). Part of the reason why we cannot draw a line, he says, is that an essential aspect of mind is memory, and a memory of sorts is displayed even by inanimate objects: “we cannot, on this ground [of memory], erect an absolute barrier between mind and matter. … [I]nanimate matter, to some slight extent, shows analogous behavior” (p. 306). In the summary he adds,

The events that happen in our minds are part of the course of nature, and we do not know that the events which happen elsewhere are of a totally different kind. The physical world…is perhaps less rigidly determined by causal laws than it was thought to be; one might, more or less fancifully, attribute even to the atom a kind of limited free will (p. 311).

Perhaps Russell’s clearest statement came in his Portraits from Memory (1956). Memory is “the most essential characteristic of mind, … using this word [memory] in its broadest sense to include every influence of past experience on present reactions” (pp. 153-4). As before, memory applies to all physical objects and systems:

This [memory] also can be illustrated in a lesser degree by the behavior of inorganic matter. A watercourse which at most times is dry gradually wears a channel down a gully at the times when it flows, and subsequent rains follow [a similar] course… You may say, if you like, that the river bed ‘remembers’ previous occasions when it experienced cooling streams. … You would say [this] was a flight of fancy because you are of the opinion that rivers and river beds do not ‘think’. But if thinking consists of certain modifications of behavior owing to former occurrences, then we shall have to say that the river bed thinks, though its thinking is somewhat rudimentary (p. 155).

In contrast to Whitehead, Charles Hartshorne articulated a clear and explicit form of process panpsychism. Beginning with his Beyond Humanism (1937), he laid out the unambiguous position that all true individuals possess a kind of psyche: “Molecules, atoms, and electrons all show more analogy of behavior to animals than do sticks and stones. The constitutions of inorganic masses may then after all belong on the scale of organic being…” (pp. 111-112). Elaborating on this notion over four decades, through such articles as “Panpsychism” (1950), “Physics and Psychics” (1977), and “The Rights of the Subhuman World” (1979), his panpsychism (or, “psychicalism”) is a clear and consistent theme. He combined the insights of Leibniz with Whitehead’s process view into a system which, he claimed, resolved many long-standing philosophical problems: most notably that it serves as a third way between dualism and materialism. Ultimately, panpsychism/psychicalism is, he says, the most viable ontology available to us—certainly preferable to an utterly unintelligible materialism: “the concept of ‘mere dead insentient matter’ is an appeal to invincible ignorance. At no time will this expression ever constitute knowledge” (1977: 95).

Many other great thinkers of the twentieth century promoted panpsychist ideas, including:

• F. S. C. Schiller: “A stone, no doubt, does not apprehend us as spiritual beings… But does this amount to saying that it does not apprehend us at all, and takes no note whatever of our existence? Not at all; it is aware of us and affected by us on the plane on which its own existence is passed… It faithfully exercises all the physical functions, and influences us by so doing. It gravitates and resists pressure, and obstructs…vibrations, and so forth, and makes itself respected as such a body. And it treats us as if of a like nature with itself, on the level of its understanding…” (1907: 442).
• Samuel Alexander: “there is nothing dead, or senseless in the universe, [even] Space-Time itself being animated”(1920: 69).
• John Dewey : “[T]here is nothing which marks off the plant from the physico-chemical activity of inanimate bodies. The latter also are subject to conditions of disturbed inner equilibrium, which lead to activity in relation to surrounding things, and which terminate after a cycle of changes…” (1925: 253).
• Sir Arthur Eddington: “The stuff of the world is mind-stuff” (1928: 276).
• J. B. S. Haldane: “We do not find obvious evidence of life or mind in so-called inert matter…; but if the scientific point of view is correct, we shall ultimately find them, at least in rudimentary form, all through the universe” (1932: 13).
• J. Huxley: “[M]ind or something of the nature as mind must exist throughout the entire universe. This is, I believe, the truth” (1942: 141).
• Teilhard de Chardin: “there is necessarily a double aspect to [matter’s] structure… [C]o-extensive with their Without, there is a Within to things.” “[W]e are logically forced to assume the existence in rudimentary form…of some sort of psyche in every corpuscle, even in those (the mega-molecules and below) whose complexity is of such a low or modest order as to render it (the psyche) imperceptible…” (1959: 56, 301).
• C. H. Waddington: “[S]omething must go on in the simplest inanimate things which can be described in the same language as would be used to describe our self-awareness” (1961: 121).
• Gregory Bateson: “The elementary cybernetic system with its messages in circuit is, in fact, the simplest unit of mind; … More complicated systems are perhaps more worthy to be called mental systems, but essentially this is what we are talking about. … We get a picture, then, of mind as synonymous with cybernetic system… [W]e know that within Mind in the widest sense there will be a hierarchy of subsystems, any one of which we can call an individual mind” (1972: 459-60).
• Freeman Dyson: “The laws [of physics] leave a place for mind in the description of every molecule… In other words, mind is already inherent in every electron, and the processes of human consciousness differ only in degree and not in kind…” (1979: 249).
• David Bohm: “That which we experience as mind…will in a natural way ultimately reach the level of the wavefunction and of the ‘dance’ of the particles. There is no unbridgeable gap or barrier between any of these levels. … It is implied that, in some sense, a rudimentary consciousness is present even at the level of particle physics” (1986: 131).

Panpsychism enters the 21^st century with vigor and diversity of thought. A number of recent works have focused attention on it. If we look back to the year 1996 we find two books that contributed to a resurrection of sorts. First, Chalmers’ The Conscious Mind lays out a naturalistic dualism theory of mind in which he suggests (with an apparent diffidence) that mind can be associated with ubiquitous information states—following Bateson and Bohm, though without citing their panpsychist views. His relatively detailed discussion of panpsychism sparked a resurgence of discussion on the matter, and contributed to a wider interest. Also, Abram’s Spell of the Sensuous argued from a phenomenological basis for a return to an animistic worldview, though his work was more poetic essay than detailed philosophical inquiry. In 1998 process philosopher David Ray Griffin published Unsnarling the World-Knot, a major milestone in panpsychist philosophy. Griffin supplies a detailed and scholarly assessment of the subject, though with a strong focus on the process view, and with only a cursory historical study.

Into the present century, Christian DeQuincey’s Radical Nature (2002) offers another process perspective, and a more satisfying review of the historical aspect. In 2003 there were two more books dedicated to panpsychism: David Clarke’s Panpsychism and the Religious Attitude, and Freya Mathews’ For Love of Matter. Clarke again takes the process view, underscoring the dominance of this philosophical perspective on the discussion. Mathews moves into new territory; drawing inspiration from Schopenhauer, she crafts a truly metaphysical philosophy in which humans are sensitive participants in an animate cosmos. Gregg Rosenberg released a nominally panpsychist approach to mind in 2004, with his book A Place for Consciousness. In 2005, Skrbina published the first-ever comprehensive study of the subject, Panpsychism in the West. Most recently, Galen Strawson has presented a forceful argument for panpsychism based on the inexplicability of emergence of mind (see Section 4).

Thus, at present we can discern at least six active lines of inquiry into panpsychism:

1. the Process Philosophy view, as conceived by Bergson and Whitehead, and developed by Hartshorne, Griffin, DeQuincey, and Clarke;
2. the Quantum Physics approach, as developed by Bohm, Hameroff, and others;
3. the Information Theory approach, arising from the work of Bateson, Wheeler (1994), Bohm, and Chalmers;
4. the Part-Whole Hierarchy, as envisioned by Cardano and elaborated by Koestler (1967) and Wilber (1995);
5. the Nonlinear Dynamics approach, as inspired by Peirce (1892) and further articulated by Skrbina (1994, 2001); and
6. Strawson’s (2006) “real physicalism” (see Section 4).

These areas all offer significant opportunity for development and articulation. They hold out the hope of resolving otherwise intractable problems of emergentism and mechanism, especially when so many conventional approaches have reached a dead end. As Nagel, Searle, and others have noted, the problems of mind and consciousness are so difficult that “drastic actions” are warranted—perhaps even as drastic as panpsychism.

Panpsychism, with its long list of advocates and sympathizers, is a robust and respectable approach to mind. It offers a naturalistic escape from Cartesian dualism and Christian theology. And, by undermining the mechanistic worldview, it promises to resolve not only long-standing philosophical problems but persistent social and ecological problems as well. Many great thinkers, from Empedocles and Epicurus to Campanella and LaMettrie, Fechner and James to Gregory Bateson, have recognized the potential for the panpsychist view to fundamentally alter, for the better, our outlook on the world. An animated worldview is not only philosophically rigorous, but it can have far-reaching and unanticipated effects.

3. Arguments: Pro and Con

An analysis of historical views, and recent discussions by such individuals as Griffin (1998), Popper (1977), McGinn (1997), and Seager (1995), demonstrate a number of distinct arguments for, and against, panpsychism. Skrbina (2005) identifies a total of six objections and twelve supporting arguments, though with some overlap between them. Below is a summary of the more compelling arguments and objections.

The first major argument for panpsychism is also one of the oldest: the Argument from Continuity. This argument, which is expressed in a variety of forms, claims that there is some critical thread of continuity among all things—a thread intimately related to the processes of mind. The particular entity that is continuous varies, but is typically expressed as either a substance or as a common form, structure, or function. We humans possess mind-like qualities that are a direct consequence of some substance, form, or structure; hence all things, to the degree that they share this common nature, have a corresponding share in mentality.

This is best illustrated through examples. The earliest such argument was presented by Anaximenes, with his arche of pneuma. As a kind of airy spirit, the pneuma accounted for our own minds but also permeated and sustained the entire cosmos and all things in it. Anaxagoras’ nous, and Heraclitus’ pyr, or fire, served a similar purpose, and thus were also arguments by continuity. Empedocles and Plato argued for pluralist, rather than monist, continuity. They saw all things as composed of the four elements (fire, air, water, and earth), and these elements were either souls in themselves (Empedocles), or the basis for human, cosmic, and other soul (Plato).

Among the German philosophers, Herder’s Kraft (force or power) played a similar role. For Schopenhauer, the will was our essential inner nature; since we are simply an “object among objects,” all things must possess an inner will. Fechner (1848/1946) emphasized the functional similarity between humans and, for example, plants. Though obviously different in many ways, living plants share essential functional qualities with humans, both representing a kind of living dynamism that suggests an inner striving and desire, a joy in being alive. Later, the American philosopher Dewey made a related case, stressing the continuity between living and nonliving systems.

At the heart of these arguments is an attempt to draw a fundamental analogy between humans and nonhumans. Some philosophers prefer to call such arguments “analogical,” and for good reason. But this is not sufficiently precise. Nearly every conceivable argument for panpsychism must start from the fact of our own human mind, and draw some analogy from that. It is the nature of the analogy that distinguishes the arguments. The continuity arguments are one particular form of analogical thinking, and hence deserve special designation.

In order to oppose an argument by continuity, one must either refute the existence of the substance or structure, or deny that it relates to mind in any fundamental way—the latter being the more common approach. The critic may argue that the continuity analogy simply fails to hold; hence we have the Inconclusive Analogy objection. Such a critic typically would take the extreme cases of a human versus a rock or an atom, and argue that no relevant analogy can be made. But of course, what seems obvious in the extreme cases is less so when one examines the intermediate points; it is there that the critic has to make his case.

A second general argument for panpsychism, also dating back to ancient Greece, relates to the notion of emergence of mind. The Greeks developed the idea that ex nihilo, nihil fit: out of nothing comes nothing. We thus get the argument that mind cannot arise from no-mind, and hence that mind must have been present at the very origin of things. This is the Argument from Non-Emergence. An extended treatment follows in Section 4.

The Non-Emergence Argument is countered by claiming, naturally, that emergence of mind is in fact intelligible and explicable (this is the majority view, but no philosopher to date has succeeded in giving a widely-accepted explanation for it). Popper (1977) was perhaps the first to use emergence as an objection to panpsychism, but recently an entire volume was dedicated to this topic; see Strawson, et al (2006).

With the advent of Darwin’s theory of evolution in the mid-1800’s there came new support for both continuity and non-emergence arguments. If humans evolved from lower animals, they from single-celled creatures, and they in turn from nonliving matter, then the continuity of beings suggests a continuity of the fundamental qualities of experience, awareness, and mind. Evolutionary continuity over time makes difficult any attempt to define the supposed point in history at which mind suddenly appeared. Haeckel (1892) was the first to offer an evolutionary argument, but Paulsen, Royce, Waddington, and Rensch made essentially the same claim.

Others expressed it differently. There is, they said, no place within the hierarchy of organism complexity—the so-called phylogenetic chain—where one can “draw a line” to distinguish those with mind from those without. Clifford (1874) was perhaps the first to put it this way:

[I]t is impossible for anybody to point out the particular place…where [absence of consciousness] can be supposed to have taken place. […] [E]ven in the very lowest organisms, even in the Amoeba…there is something or other, inconceivably simple to us, which is of the same nature with our own consciousness… [Furthermore] we cannot stop at organic matter, [but] we are obliged to assume…that along with every motion of matter, whether organic or inorganic, there is some fact which corresponds to the mental fact in ourselves (pp. 60-61).

Others, including Globus, Chalmers (1996), and Rensch, have argued in similar terms.

To counter this argument one must identify a plausible point at which to break the hierarchical chain. Where, and why, does the continuity suddenly fail to hold? All agree that it holds, to some degree, for higher mammals, such as chimpanzees and dolphins. If the critic believes it to fail with rocks and atoms, he must explain this discrepancy—otherwise the objection is invalid. To date few have attempted this. Tye (2000: 171) is one exception; he draws the line at fish and honey bees, which, he says, are the simplest beings that experience a kind of “phenomenal consciousness.” Whether his rationale for this line is acceptable is an open question.

Two final objections bear mentioning. First is the Not Testable, or No Signs, objection: there is no empirical evidence, nor any conceivable test, that could point to the presence of mind in lesser beings. McGinn (1997) and Seager (1995) have raised this point, among others. Yet it is hard to see what might actually count as valid evidence of mind. As Royce and Peirce have observed, simpler minds may appear to us as law-like phenomena. Analogy and rational thinking about metaphysical continuity are all we have to go on. Given the conceptual difficulty in determining, with certainty, the existence of minds in other human beings, one should not be surprised that definitive evidence of lesser minds is lacking. Certainly there is, we may say, an epistemological gap here, in that our knowledge is deficient; but this does not imply an ontological gap, that is, an absence of mind in other things.

Lastly we have the Combination Problem: If mind is supposed to exist in atoms or cells, then higher-order minds, such as humans have, must be some kind of combination or sum of these lesser minds. But it is inconceivable how such a summing would work and how it might account for the richness of experience that we all feel. Because panpsychism cannot account for higher mind, the objector says, it must be false.

We should first note that this is not an objection to panpsychism per se, but only to the particular theory that says that higher-order mind must be composed of lower-order mental elements. Granting this, there remains the general question of the relation between higher- and lower-order minds within the same being. As such, the Combination Problem may be better seen as a call for details.

The problem was first addressed by Leibniz in the late 1600’s. His panpsychist theory of monads allowed for a single dominant monad to unify the collective, and serve as the mind of the body. Kant, in an early work Dreams of a Spirit-Seer, criticized Leibniz’s theory and thus became the first to employ the Combination Problem against panpsychism. In 1890 William James raised the issue, in objection to Clifford’s “mind-stuff” form of panpsychism—though by 1909 he had changed his mind, and stopped viewing combination as an insurmountable hurdle. More recently Seager (1995) highlights the combination problem as one of particular importance, as do a number of contributors to Strawson, et al (2006).

4. Panpsychism vs. Emergentism

The issue of emergence of mind is important because it is the mutually exclusive counterpart to panpsychism: either you are a panpsychist, or you are an emergentist. Either mind was present in things from the very beginning or it appeared (emerged) at some point in the history of evolution. If, however, emergence is inexplicable, or is less viable, then one is left with the panpsychist alternative. This line of reasoning, as mentioned above, is the argument from Non-Emergence.

To briefly recap the historical forms of this argument: it was first formulated by Epicurus circa 300 B.C.E. As we have seen, he argued that the mental quality called will could not arise from non-will, and therefore that the atoms from which everything was made had to possess a kind of will themselves. Will cannot emerge ex nihilo, and thus is present in the very constituents of matter.

Others were likewise convinced by this approach. Telesio held that “nothing can give what it does not possess,” and thus it is inconceivable that mind arises from no-mind. Patrizi believed, similarly, that nothing can be in the effect that is not in the cause; hence, the elements themselves must have life and soul, which they in turn grant to all things. In 1620 Campanella wrote: “If the animals are sentient…and sentience does not come from nothing, the elements whereby they and everything else are brought into being must be said to be sentient, because what the result has the cause must have” (in Dooley, 1995: 39).

The German panpsychists also found this argument compelling. Fechner argued that “animate beings cannot arise from inanimate.” Paulsen examined the question, “Whence did psychical life arise?” His answer: it did not arise, but was present at the origin of things. The sudden appearance of a mental realm “would be an absolute world-riddle; it would mean a creation out of nothing” (1892: 100).

The Non-Emergence argument resurfaced in the late twentieth century with the work of zoologist Sewall Wright. In his 1977 article “Panpsychism and Science” he argued that brute emergence of mind would be a kind of inexplicable miracle in the natural order of things: “Emergence of mind from no mind at all is sheer magic” (p. 82). Thomas Nagel flirted with this argument in his “Panpsychism” essay (1979), but opted not to follow through on all the implications.

The basic problem is this: emergence seems, at first glance, to be a reasonable enough idea, but when pressed for details it comes up sorely lacking. In fact, emergence of mind is very difficult to sensibly explain. Mind is not like five-fingered-ness, or warm-bloodedness. These things, which clearly did emerge, are ontologically unlike mind. They are simply reconfigurations of existing physical matter, whereas mind is of a different ontological order. It is too fundamental an aspect of existence to be comparable to ordinary biological structural features.

Furthermore, emergence of mind is not just some fact of the distant evolutionary past; it must recur every day, in, for example, the development of a human embryo. That is, if a human egg is utterly without mind, and a newborn infant has one, when in the ontogenetic process does mind emerge? Why just there? So in addition to the phylogenetic (historical) emergence problem, we have the related ontogenetic problem as well.

Given that there are very few panpsychists in the world, most everyone is an emergentist. But, as Galen Strawson (2006) has recently emphasized, emergentism is not a forgone conclusion. In fact, it is highly dubious. His piece “Realistic Monism: Why Physicalism Entails Panpsychism” presses this point with notable urgency, and offers the most detailed and complete version of the Non-Emergence argument to date. If one is not a panpsychist, then one necessarily believes that only some subset of creatures is privileged to possess mind. The vast remainder of nature, then, is utterly non-mental. This, Strawson observes, is pure presumption: “there is absolutely no evidence whatsoever” (p. 20) for a non-mental component of reality. We simply assume it to be so.

Strawson’s argument, in a nutshell, is this:

• There is one ultimate reality to the universe (“realistic physicalism,” as he calls it).
• Mental (that is, experiential) phenomena are a part of this monistic reality. Therefore, experiential phenomena are physical phenomena, rightly understood.
• Radical-kind, or brute, emergence is impossible; mental phenomena cannot arise from any purely non-mental stuff.
• Therefore, the one reality and all things in it are necessarily experiential.

If we are to be physicalists, Strawson says, then let us be real physicalists and take the implications seriously. When we do so, we find that “something akin to panpsychism is not merely one possible form of realistic physicalism, but the only possible form, and hence, the only possible form of physicalism tout court” (p. 9).

Strawson tackles head-on those who implicitly endorse emergence. He asks, “Does this conception of emergence make sense? I think that it is very, very hard to understand what it is supposed to involve. I think that it is incoherent, in fact, and that this general way of talking of emergence has acquired an air of plausibility…for some simply because it has been appealed to many times in the face of a seeming mystery” (p. 12). He gives a number of examples of putative emergence, showing that each is really unintelligible. His slogan: “emergence can’t be brute,” that is, higher-order mind can emerge from lower-order, but mind cannot possibly emerge from no-mind. “Brute emergence is by definition a miracle every time it occurs,” which is rationally inconceivable.

Panpsychism thus offers a kind of resolution to the problem of emergence, and is supported by several other arguments as well. The viability of panpsychism is no longer really in question. At issue is the specific form it might take, and what its implications are. Panpsychism suggests a radically different worldview, one that is fundamentally at odds with the dominant mechanistic conception of the universe. Arguably, it is precisely this mechanistic view—which sees the universe and everything in it as a kind of giant machine—that lies at the root of many of our philosophical, sociological, and environmental problems. Panpsychism, by challenging this worldview at its root, potentially offers new solutions to some very old problems.

5. References and Further Reading

• Abram, D. 1996. Spell of the Sensuous. New York: Vintage.
• Alexander, S. 1920. Space, Time, and Deity. 2 Vols. London: Macmillan.
• Aristotle. 1995. The Complete Works of Aristotle. Ed. J. Barnes. Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
• Bateson, G. 1972. Steps to an Ecology of Mind. New York: Ballantine.
• Bergson, H. 1907/1911. Creative Evolution. Trans. A. Mitchell. New York: H. Holt.
• Bergson, H. 1922/1965. Duration and Simultaneity. Trans. L. Jacobson. Indianapolis: Bobbs-Merrill.
• Bohm, D. 1986. “A New Theory of the Relationship of Mind and Matter.” Journal of the American Society of Psychical Research, 80(2).
• Bonansea, B. 1969. Tommaso Campanella. Washington DC: Catholic University Press.
• Brickman, B. 1941. An Introduction to Francesco Patrizi’s Nova de Universis Philosophia. New York.
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