Hedonism

The term “hedonism,” from the Greek word ἡδονή (hēdonē) for pleasure, refers to several related theories about what is good for us, how we should behave, and what motivates us to behave in the way that we do. All hedonistic theories identify pleasure and pain as the only important elements of whatever phenomena they are designed to describe.  If hedonistic theories identified pleasure and pain as merely two important elements, instead of the only important elements of what they are describing, then they would not be nearly as unpopular as they all are. However, the claim that pleasure and pain are the only things of ultimate importance is what makes hedonism distinctive and philosophically interesting.

Philosophical hedonists tend to focus on hedonistic theories of value, and especially of well-being (the good life for the one living it). As a theory of value, hedonism states that all and only pleasure is intrinsically valuable and all and only pain is intrinsically not valuable. Hedonists usually define pleasure and pain broadly, such that both physical and mental phenomena are included. Thus, a gentle massage and recalling a fond memory are both considered to cause pleasure and stubbing a toe and hearing about the death of a loved one are both considered to cause pain. With pleasure and pain so defined, hedonism as a theory about what is valuable for us is intuitively appealing. Indeed, its appeal is evidenced by the fact that nearly all historical and contemporary treatments of well-being allocate at least some space for discussion of hedonism.  Unfortunately for hedonism, the discussions rarely endorse it and some even deplore its focus on pleasure.

This article begins by clarifying the different types of hedonistic theories and the labels they are often given. Then, hedonism’s ancient origins and its subsequent development are reviewed. The majority of this article is concerned with describing the important theoretical divisions within Prudential Hedonism and discussing the major criticisms of these approaches.

Table of Contents

1. Types of Hedonism
   1. Folk Hedonism
   2. Value Hedonism and Prudential Hedonism
   3. Motivational Hedonism
   4. Normative Hedonism
   5. Hedonistic Egoism
   6. Hedonistic Utilitarianism
2. The Origins of Hedonism
   1. Cārvāka
   2. Aritippus and the Cyrenaics
   3. Epicurus
   4. The Oyster Example
3. The Development of Hedonism
   1. Bentham
   2. Mill
   3. Moore
4. Contemporary Varieties of Hedonism
   1. The Main Divisions
   2. Pleasure as Sensation
   3. Pleasure as Intrinsically Valuable Experience
   4. Pleasure as Pro-Attitude
5. Contemporary Objections
   1. Pleasure is Not the Only Source of Intrinsic Value
   2. Some Pleasure is Not Valuable
   3. There is No Coherent and Unifying Definition of Pleasure
6. The Future of Hedonism
7. References and Further Reading
   1. Primary Sources
   2. Secondary and Mixed Sources

1. Types of Hedonism

a. Folk Hedonism

When the term “hedonism” is used in modern literature, or by non-philosophers in their everyday talk, its meaning is quite different from the meaning it takes when used in the discussions of philosophers. Non-philosophers tend to think of a hedonist as a person who seeks out pleasure for themselves without any particular regard for their own future well-being or for the well-being of others. According to non-philosophers, then, a stereotypical hedonist is someone who never misses an opportunity to indulge of the pleasures of sex, drugs, and rock ‘n’ roll, even if the indulgences are likely to lead to relationship problems, health problems, regrets, or sadness for themselves or others. Philosophers commonly refer to this everyday understanding of hedonism as “Folk Hedonism.” Folk Hedonism is a rough combination of Motivational Hedonism, Hedonistic Egoism, and a reckless lack of foresight.

b. Value Hedonism and Prudential Hedonism

When philosophers discuss hedonism, they are most likely to be referring to hedonism about value, and especially the slightly more specific theory, hedonism about well-being. Hedonism as a theory about value (best referred to as Value Hedonism) holds that all and only pleasure is intrinsically valuable and all and only pain is intrinsically disvaluable. The term “intrinsically” is an important part of the definition and is best understood in contrast to the term “instrumentally.” Something is intrinsically valuable if it is valuable for its own sake. Pleasure is thought to be intrinsically valuable because, even if it did not lead to any other benefit, it would still be good to experience. Money is an example of an instrumental good; its value for us comes from what we can do with it (what we can buy with it). The fact that a copious amount of money has no value if no one ever sells anything reveals that money lacks intrinsic value. Value Hedonism reduces everything of value to pleasure. For example, a Value Hedonist would explain the instrumental value of money by describing how the things we can buy with money, such as food, shelter, and status-signifying goods, bring us pleasure or help us to avoid pain.

Hedonism as a theory about well-being (best referred to as Prudential Hedonism) is more specific than Value Hedonism because it stipulates what the value is for. Prudential Hedonism holds that all and only pleasure intrinsically makes people’s lives go better for them and all and only pain intrinsically makes their lives go worse for them. Some philosophers replace “people” with “animals” or “sentient creatures,” so as to apply Prudential Hedonism more widely. A good example of this comes from Peter Singer’s work on animals and ethics. Singer questions why some humans can see the intrinsic disvalue in human pain, but do not also accept that it is bad for sentient non-human animals to experience pain.

When Prudential Hedonists claim that happiness is what they value most, they intend happiness to be understood as a preponderance of pleasure over pain. An important distinction between Prudential Hedonism and Folk Hedonism is that Prudential Hedonists usually understand that pursuing pleasure and avoiding pain in the very short-term is not always the best strategy for achieving the best long-term balance of pleasure over pain.

Prudential Hedonism is an integral part of several derivative types of hedonistic theory, all of which have featured prominently in philosophical debates of the past. Since Prudential Hedonism plays this important role, the majority of this article is dedicated to Prudential Hedonism. First, however, the main derivative types of hedonism are briefly discussed.

c. Motivational Hedonism

Motivational Hedonism (more commonly referred to by the less descriptive label, “Psychological Hedonism“) is the theory that the desires to encounter pleasure and to avoid pain guide all of our behavior. Most accounts of Motivational Hedonism include both conscious and unconscious desires for pleasure, but emphasize the latter. Epicurus, William James, Sigmund Freud, Jeremy Bentham, John Stuart Mill, and (on one interpretation) even Charles Darwin have all argued for varieties of Motivational Hedonism. Bentham used the idea to support his theory of Hedonistic Utilitarianism (discussed below). Weak versions of Motivational Hedonism hold that the desires to seek pleasure and avoid pain often or always have some influence on our behavior. Weak versions are generally considered to be uncontroversially true and not especially useful for philosophy.

Philosophers have been more interested in strong accounts of Motivational Hedonism, which hold that all behavior is governed by the desires to encounter pleasure and to avoid pain (and only those desires). Strong accounts of Motivational Hedonism have been used to support some of the normative types of hedonism and to argue against non-hedonistic normative theories. One of the most notable mentions of Motivational Hedonism is Plato’s Ring of Gyges example in The Republic. Plato’s Socrates is discussing with Glaucon how men would react if they were to possess a ring that gives its wearer immense powers, including invisibility. Glaucon believes that a strong version of Motivational Hedonism is true, but Socrates does not. Glaucon asserts that, emboldened with the power provided by the Ring of Gyges, everyone would succumb to the inherent and ubiquitous desire to pursue their own ends at the expense of others. Socrates disagrees, arguing that good people would be able to overcome this desire because of their strong love of justice, fostered through philosophising.

Strong accounts of Motivational Hedonism currently garner very little support for similar reasons. Many examples of seemingly-pain-seeking acts performed out of a sense of duty are well-known – from the soldier who jumps on a grenade to save his comrades to that time you rescued a trapped dog only to be (predictably) bitten in the process. Introspective evidence also weighs against strong accounts of Motivational Hedonism; many of the decisions we make seem to be based on motives other than seeking pleasure and avoiding pain. Given these reasons, the burden of proof is considered to be squarely on the shoulders of anyone wishing to argue for a strong account of Motivational Hedonism.

d. Normative Hedonism

Value Hedonism, occasionally with assistance from Motivational Hedonism, has been used to argue for specific theories of right action (theories that explain which actions are morally permissible or impermissible and why). The theory that happiness should be pursued (that pleasure should be pursued and pain should be avoided) is referred to as Normative Hedonism and sometimes Ethical Hedonism.  There are two major types of Normative Hedonism, Hedonistic Egoism and Hedonistic Utilitarianism. Both types commonly use happiness (defined as pleasure minus pain) as the sole criterion for determining the moral rightness or wrongness of an action. Important variations within each of these two main types specify either the actual resulting happiness (after the act) or the predicted resulting happiness (before the act) as the moral criterion. Although both major types of Normative Hedonism have been accused of being repugnant, Hedonistic Egoism is considered the most offensive.

e. Hedonistic Egoism

Hedonistic Egoism is a hedonistic version of egoism, the theory that we should, morally speaking, do whatever is most in our own interests. Hedonistic Egoism is the theory that we ought, morally speaking, to do whatever makes us happiest – that is whatever provides us with the most net pleasure after pain is subtracted. The most repugnant feature of this theory is that one never has to ascribe any value whatsoever to the consequences for anyone other than oneself. For example, a Hedonistic Egoist who did not feel saddened by theft would be morally required to steal, even from needy orphans (if he thought he could get away with it). Would-be defenders of Hedonistic Egoism often point out that performing acts of theft, murder, treachery and the like would not make them happier overall because of the guilt, the fear of being caught, and the chance of being caught and punished. The would-be defenders tend to surrender, however, when it is pointed out that a Hedonistic Egoist is morally obliged by their own theory to pursue an unusual kind of practical education; a brief and possibly painful training period that reduces their moral emotions of sympathy and guilt. Such an education might be achieved by desensitising over-exposure to, and performance of, torture on innocents. If Hedonistic Egoists underwent such an education, their reduced capacity for sympathy and guilt would allow them to take advantage of any opportunities to perform pleasurable, but normally-guilt-inducing, actions, such as stealing from the poor.

Hedonistic Egoism is very unpopular amongst philosophers, not just for this reason, but also because it suffers from all of the objections that apply to Prudential Hedonism.

f. Hedonistic Utilitarianism

Hedonistic Utilitarianism is the theory that the right action is the one that produces (or is most likely to produce) the greatest net happiness for all concerned. Hedonistic Utilitarianism is often considered fairer than Hedonistic Egoism because the happiness of everyone involved (everyone who is affected or likely to be affected) is taken into account and given equal weight. Hedonistic Utilitarians, then, tend to advocate not stealing from needy orphans because to do so would usually leave the orphan far less happy and the (probably better-off) thief only slightly happier (assuming he felt no guilt). Despite treating all individuals equally, Hedonistic Utilitarianism is still seen as objectionable by some because it assigns no intrinsic moral value to justice, friendship, truth, or any of the many other goods that are thought by some to be irreducibly valuable. For example, a Hedonistic Utilitarian would be morally obliged to publicly execute an innocent friend of theirs if doing so was the only way to promote the greatest happiness overall. Although unlikely, such a situation might arise if a child was murdered in a small town and the lack of suspects was causing large-scale inter-ethnic violence. Some philosophers argue that executing an innocent friend is immoral precisely because it ignores the intrinsic values of justice, friendship, and possibly truth.

Hedonistic Utilitarianism is rarely endorsed by philosophers, but mainly because of its reliance on Prudential Hedonism as opposed to its utilitarian element. Non-hedonistic versions of utilitarianism are about as popular as the other leading theories of right action, especially when it is the actions of institutions that are being considered.

2. The Origins of Hedonism

a. Cārvāka

Perhaps the earliest written record of hedonism comes from the Cārvāka, an Indian philosophical tradition based on the Barhaspatya sutras. The Cārvāka persisted for two thousand years (from about 600 B.C.E.). Most notably, the Cārvāka advocated scepticism and Hedonistic Egoism – that the right action is the one that brings the actor the most net pleasure. The Cārvāka acknowledged that some pain often accompanied, or was later caused by, sensual pleasure, but that pleasure was worth it.

b. Aritippus and the Cyrenaics

The Cyrenaics, founded by Aristippus (c. 435-356 B.C.E.), were also sceptics and Hedonistic Egoists. Although the paucity of original texts makes it difficult to confidently state all of the justifications for the Cyrenaics’ positions, their overall stance is clear enough. The Cyrenaics believed pleasure was the ultimate good and everyone should pursue all immediate pleasures for themselves. They considered bodily pleasures better than mental pleasures, presumably because they were more vivid or trustworthy. The Cyrenaics also recommended pursuing immediate pleasures and avoiding immediate pains with scant or no regard for future consequences. Their reasoning for this is even less clear, but is most plausibly linked to their sceptical views – perhaps that what we can be most sure of in this uncertain existence is our current bodily pleasures.

c. Epicurus

Epicurus (c. 341-271 B.C.E.), founder of Epicureanism, developed a Normative Hedonism in stark contrast to that of Aristippus. The Epicureanism of Epicurus is also quite the opposite to the common usage of Epicureanism; while we might like to go on a luxurious “Epicurean” holiday packed with fine dining and moderately excessive wining, Epicurus would warn us that we are only setting ourselves up for future pain. For Epicurus, happiness was the complete absence of bodily and especially mental pains, including fear of the Gods and desires for anything other than the bare necessities of life. Even with only the limited excesses of ancient Greece on offer, Epicurus advised his followers to avoid towns, and especially marketplaces, in order to limit the resulting desires for unnecessary things. Once we experience unnecessary pleasures, such as those from sex and rich food, we will then suffer from painful and hard to satisfy desires for more and better of the same. No matter how wealthy we might be, Epicurus would argue, our desires will eventually outstrip our means and interfere with our ability to live tranquil, happy lives. Epicureanism is generally egoistic, in that it encourages everyone to pursue happiness for themselves. However, Epicureans would be unlikely to commit any of the selfish acts we might expect from other egoists because Epicureans train themselves to desire only the very basics, which gives them very little reason to do anything to interfere with the affairs of others.

d. The Oyster Example

With the exception of a brief period discussed below, Hedonism has been generally unpopular ever since its ancient beginnings. Although criticisms of the ancient forms of hedonism were many and varied, one in particular was heavily cited. In Philebus, Plato’s Socrates and one of his many foils, Protarchus in this instance, are discussing the role of pleasure in the good life. Socrates asks Protarchus to imagine a life without much pleasure but full of the higher cognitive processes, such as knowledge, forethought and consciousness and to compare it with a life that is the opposite. Socrates describes this opposite life as having perfect pleasure but the mental life of an oyster, pointing out that the subject of such a life would not be able to appreciate any of the pleasure within it. The harrowing thought of living the pleasurable but unthinking life of an oyster causes Protarchus to abandon his hedonistic argument. The oyster example is now easily avoided by clarifying that pleasure is best understood as being a conscious experience, so any sensation that we are not consciously aware of cannot be pleasure.

3. The Development of Hedonism

a. Bentham

Normative and Motivational Hedonism were both at their most popular during the heyday of Empiricism in the 18^th and 19^th Centuries. Indeed, this is the only period during which any kind of hedonism could be considered popular at all. During this period, two Hedonistic Utilitarians, Jeremy Bentham (1748-1832) and his protégé John Stuart Mill (1806-1873), were particularly influential. Their theories are similar in many ways, but are notably distinct on the nature of pleasure.

Bentham argued for several types of hedonism, including those now referred to as Prudential Hedonism, Hedonistic Utilitarianism, and Motivational Hedonism (although his commitment to strong Motivational Hedonism eventually began to wane). Bentham argued that happiness was the ultimate good and that happiness was pleasure and the absence of pain. He acknowledged the egoistic and hedonistic nature of peoples’ motivation, but argued that the maximization of collective happiness was the correct criterion for moral behavior. Bentham’s greatest happiness principle states that actions are immoral if they are not the action that appears to maximise the happiness of all the people likely to be affected; only the action that appears to maximise the happiness of all the people likely to be affected is the morally right action.

Bentham devised the greatest happiness principle to justify the legal reforms he also argued for. He understood that he could not conclusively prove that the principle was the correct criterion for morally right action, but also thought that it should be accepted because it was fair and better than existing criteria for evaluating actions and legislation. Bentham thought that his Hedonic Calculus could be applied to situations to see what should, morally speaking, be done in a situation. The Hedonic Calculus is a method of counting the amount of pleasure and pain that would likely be caused by different actions. The Hedonic Calculus required a methodology for measuring pleasure, which in turn required an understanding of the nature of pleasure and specifically what aspects of pleasure were valuable for us.

Bentham’s Hedonic Calculus identifies several aspects of pleasure that contribute to its value, including certainty, propinquity, extent, intensity, and duration. The Hedonic Calculus also makes use of two future-pleasure-or-pain-related aspects of actions – fecundity and purity. Certainty refers to the likelihood that the pleasure or pain will occur. Propinquity refers to how long away (in terms of time) the pleasure or pain is. Fecundity refers to the likelihood of the pleasure or pain leading to more of the same sensation. Purity refers to the likelihood of the pleasure or pain leading to some of the opposite sensation. Extent refers to the number of people the pleasure or pain is likely to affect. Intensity refers to the felt strength of the pleasure or pain. Duration refers to how long the pleasure or pain are felt for. It should be noted that only intensity and duration have intrinsic value for an individual. Certainty, propinquity, fecundity, and purity are all instrumentally valuable for an individual because they affect the likelihood of an individual feeling future pleasure and pain. Extent is not directly valuable for an individual’s well-being because it refers to the likelihood of other people experiencing pleasure or pain.

Bentham’s inclusion of certainty, propinquity, fecundity, and purity in the Hedonic Calculus helps to differentiate his hedonism from Folk Hedonism. Folk Hedonists rarely consider how likely their actions are to lead to future pleasure or pain, focussing instead on the pursuit of immediate pleasure and the avoidance of immediate pain. So while Folk Hedonists would be unlikely to study for an exam, anyone using Bentham’s Hedonic Calculus would consider the future happiness benefits to themselves (and possibly others) of passing the exam and then promptly begin studying.

Most importantly for Bentham’s Hedonic Calculus, the pleasure from different sources is always measured against these criteria in the same way, that is to say that no additional value is afforded to pleasures from particularly moral, clean, or culturally-sophisticated sources. For example, Bentham held that pleasure from the parlor game push-pin was just as valuable for us as pleasure from music and poetry. Since Bentham’s theory of Prudential Hedonism focuses on the quantity of the pleasure, rather than the source-derived quality of it, it is best described as a type of Quantitative Hedonism.

b. Mill

Bentham’s indifferent stance on the source of pleasures led to others disparaging his hedonism as the philosophy of swine. Even his student, John Stuart Mill, questioned whether we should believe that a satisfied pig leads a better life than a dissatisfied human or that a satisfied fool leads a better life than a dissatisfied Socrates – results that Bentham’s Quantitative Hedonism seems to endorse.

Like Bentham, Mill endorsed the varieties of hedonism now referred to as Prudential Hedonism, Hedonistic Utilitarianism, and Motivational Hedonism. Mill also thought happiness, defined as pleasure and the avoidance of pain, was the highest good. Where Mill’s hedonism differs from Bentham’s is in his understanding of the nature of pleasure. Mill argued that pleasures could vary in quality, being either higher or lower pleasures. Mill employed the distinction between higher and lower pleasures in an attempt to avoid the criticism that his hedonism was just another philosophy of swine. Lower pleasures are those associated with the body, which we share with other animals, such as pleasure from quenching thirst or having sex. Higher pleasures are those associated with the mind, which were thought to be unique to humans, such as pleasure from listening to opera, acting virtuously, and philosophising. Mill justified this distinction by arguing that those who have experienced both types of pleasure realise that higher pleasures are much more valuable. He dismissed challenges to this claim by asserting that those who disagreed lacked either the experience of higher pleasures or the capacity for such experiences. For Mill, higher pleasures were not different from lower pleasures by mere degree; they were different in kind. Since Mill’s theory of Prudential Hedonism focuses on the quality of the pleasure, rather than the amount of it, it is best described as a type of Qualitative Hedonism.

c. Moore

George Edward Moore (1873-1958) was instrumental in bringing hedonism’s brief heyday to an end. Moore’s criticisms of hedonism in general, and Mill’s hedonism in particular, were frequently cited as good reasons to reject hedonism even decades after his death. Indeed, since G. E. Moore, hedonism has been viewed by most philosophers as being an initially intuitive and interesting family of theories, but also one that is flawed on closer inspection. Moore was a pluralist about value and argued persuasively against the Value Hedonists’ central claim – that all and only pleasure is the bearer of intrinsic value. Moore’s most damaging objection against Hedonism was his heap of filth example. Moore himself thought the heap of filth example thoroughly refuted what he saw as the only potentially viable form of Prudential Hedonism – that conscious pleasure is the only thing that positively contributes to well-being. Moore used the heap of filth example to argue that Prudential Hedonism is false because pleasure is not the only thing of value.

In the heap of filth example, Moore asks the reader to imagine two worlds, one of which is exceedingly beautiful and the other a disgusting heap of filth. Moore then instructs the reader to imagine that no one would ever experience either world and asks if it is better for the beautiful world to exist than the filthy one. As Moore expected, his contemporaries tended to agree that it would be better if the beautiful world existed.  Relying on this agreement, Moore infers that the beautiful world is more valuable than the heap of filth and, therefore, that beauty must be valuable. Moore then concluded that all of the potentially viable theories of Prudential Hedonism (those that value only conscious pleasures) must be false because something, namely beauty, is valuable even when no conscious pleasure can be derived from it.

Moore’s heap of filth example has rarely been used to object to Prudential Hedonism since the 1970’s because it is not directly relevant to Prudential Hedonism (it evaluates worlds and not lives). Moore’s other objections to Prudential Hedonism also went out of favor around the same time. The demise of these arguments was partly due to mounting objections against them, but mainly because arguments more suited to the task of refuting Prudential Hedonism were developed. These arguments are discussed after the contemporary varieties of hedonism are introduced below.

4. Contemporary Varieties of Hedonism

a. The Main Divisions

Several contemporary varieties of hedonism have been defended, although usually by just a handful of philosophers or less at any one time. Other varieties of hedonism are also theoretically available but have received little or no discussion. Contemporary varieties of Prudential Hedonism can be grouped based on how they define pleasure and pain, as is done below. In addition to providing different notions of what pleasure and pain are, contemporary varieties of Prudential Hedonism also disagree about what aspect or aspects of pleasure are valuable for well-being (and the opposite for pain).

The most well-known disagreement about what aspects of pleasure are valuable occurs between Quantitative and Qualitative Hedonists. Quantitative Hedonists argue that how valuable pleasure is for well-being depends on only the amount of pleasure, and so they are only concerned with dimensions of pleasure such as duration and intensity. Quantitative Hedonism is often accused of over-valuing animalistic, simple, and debauched pleasures.

Qualitative Hedonists argue that, in addition to the dimensions related to the amount of pleasure, one or more dimensions of quality can have an impact on how pleasure affects well-being. The quality dimensions might be based on how cognitive or bodily the pleasure is (as it was for Mill), the moral status of the source of the pleasure, or some other non-amount-related dimension. Qualitative Hedonism is criticised by some for smuggling values other than pleasure into well-being by misleadingly labelling them as dimensions of pleasure. How these qualities are chosen for inclusion is also criticised for being arbitrary or ad hoc by some because inclusion of these dimensions of pleasure is often in direct response to objections that Quantitative Hedonism cannot easily deal with. That is to say, the inclusion of these dimensions is often accused of being an exercise in plastering over holes, rather than deducing corollary conclusions from existing theoretical premises. Others have argued that any dimensions of quality can be better explained in terms of dimensions of quantity. For example, they might claim that moral pleasures are no higher in quality than immoral pleasures, but that moral pleasures are instrumentally more valuable because they are likely to lead to more moments of pleasure or less moments of pain in the future.

Hedonists also have differing views about how the value of pleasure compares with the value of pain. This is not a practical disagreement about how best to measure pleasure and pain, but rather a theoretical disagreement about comparative value, such as whether pain is worse for us than an equivalent amount of pleasure is good for us. The default position is that one unit of pleasure (sometimes referred to as a Hedon) is equivalent but opposite in value to one unit of pain (sometimes referred to as a Dolor). Several Hedonistic Utilitarians have argued that reduction of pain should be seen as more important than increasing pleasure, sometimes for the Epicurean reason that pain seems worse for us than an equivalent amount of pleasure is good for us. Imagine that a magical genie offered for you to play a game with him. The game consists of you flipping a fair coin. If the coin lands on heads, then you immediately feel a burst of very intense pleasure and if it lands on tails, then you immediately feel a burst of very intense pain. Is it in your best interests to play the game?

Another area of disagreement between some Hedonists is whether pleasure is entirely internal to a person or if it includes external elements. Internalism about pleasure is the thesis that, whatever pleasure is, it is always and only inside a person. Externalism about pleasure, on the other hand, is the thesis that, pleasure is more than just a state of an individual (that is, that a necessary component of pleasure lies outside of the individual). Externalists about pleasure might, for example, describe pleasure as a function that mediates between our minds and the environment, such that every instance of pleasure has one or more integral environmental components. The vast majority of historic and contemporary versions of Prudential Hedonism consider pleasure to be an internal mental state.

Perhaps the least known disagreement about what aspects of pleasure make it valuable is the debate about whether we have to be conscious of pleasure for it to be valuable. The standard position is that pleasure is a conscious mental state, or at least that any pleasure a person is not conscious of does not intrinsically improve their well-being.

b. Pleasure as Sensation

The most common definition of pleasure is that it is a sensation, something that we identify through our senses or that we feel. Psychologists claim that we have at least ten senses, including the familiar, sight, hearing, smell, taste, and touch, but also, movement, balance, and several sub-senses of touch, including heat, cold, pressure, and pain. New senses get added to the list when it is understood that some independent physical process underpins their functioning. The most widely-used examples of pleasurable sensations are the pleasures of eating, drinking, listening to music, and having sex. Use of these examples has done little to help Hedonism avoid its debauched reputation.

It is also commonly recognised that our senses are physical processes that usually involve a mental component, such as the tickling feeling when someone blows gently on the back of your neck. If a sensation is something we identify through our sense organs, however, it is not entirely clear how to account for abstract pleasures. This is because abstract pleasures, such as a feeling of accomplishment for a job well done, do not seem to be experienced through any of the senses in the standard lists. Some Hedonists have attempted to resolve this problem by arguing for the existence of an independent pleasure sense and by defining sensation as something that we feel (regardless of whether it has been mediated by sense organs).

Most Hedonists who describe pleasure as a sensation will be Quantitative Hedonists and will argue that the pleasure from the different senses is the same. Qualitative Hedonists, in comparison, can use the framework of the senses to help differentiate between qualities of pleasure. For example, a Qualitative Hedonist might argue that pleasurable sensations from touch and movement are always lower quality than the others.

c. Pleasure as Intrinsically Valuable Experience

Hedonists have also defined pleasure as intrinsically valuable experience, that is to say any experiences that we find intrinsically valuable either are, or include, instances of pleasure. According to this definition, the reason that listening to music and eating a fine meal are both intrinsically pleasurable is because those experiences include an element of pleasure (along with the other elements specific to each activity, such as the experience of the texture of the food and the melody of the music). By itself, this definition enables Hedonists to make an argument that is close to perfectly circular. Defining pleasure as intrinsically valuable experience and well-being as all and only experiences that are intrinsically valuable allows a Hedonist to all but stipulate that Prudential Hedonism is the correct theory of well-being. Where defining pleasure as intrinsically valuable experience is not circular is in its stipulation that only experiences matter for well-being. Some well-known objections to this idea are discussed below.

Another problem with defining pleasure as intrinsically valuable experience is that the definition does not tell us very much about what pleasure is or how it can be identified. For example, knowing that pleasure is intrinsically valuable experience would not help someone to work out if a particular experience was intrinsically or just instrumentally valuable. Hedonists have attempted to respond to this problem by explaining how to find out whether an experience is intrinsically valuable.

One method is to ask yourself if you would like the experience to continue for its own sake (rather than because of what it might lead to). Wanting an experience to continue for its own sake reveals that you find it to be intrinsically valuable. While still making a coherent theory of well-being, defining intrinsically valuable experiences as those you want to perpetuate makes the theory much less hedonistic. The fact that what a person wants is the main criterion for something having intrinsic value, makes this kind of theory more in line with preference satisfaction theories of well-being. The central claim of preference satisfaction theories of well-being is that some variant of getting what one wants, or should want, under certain conditions is the only thing that intrinsically improves one’s well-being.

Another method of fleshing out the definition of pleasure as intrinsically valuable experience is to describe how intrinsically valuable experiences feel. This method remains a hedonistic one, but seems to fall back into defining pleasure as a sensation.

It has also been argued that what makes an experience intrinsically valuable is that you like or enjoy it for its own sake. Hedonists arguing for this definition of pleasure usually take pains to position their definition in between the realms of sensation and preference satisfaction. They argue that since we can like or enjoy some experiences without concurrently wanting them or feeling any particular sensation, then liking is distinct from both sensation and preference satisfaction. Liking and enjoyment are also difficult terms to define in more detail, but they are certainly easier to recognise than the rather opaque “intrinsically valuable experience.”

Merely defining pleasure as intrinsically valuable experience and intrinsically valuable experiences as those that we like or enjoy still lacks enough detail to be very useful for contemplating well-being. A potential method for making this theory more useful would be to draw on the cognitive sciences to investigate if there is a specific neurological function for liking or enjoying. Cognitive science has not reached the point where anything definitive can be said about this, but a few neuroscientists have experimental evidence that liking and wanting (at least in regards to food) are neurologically distinct processes in rats and have argued that it should be the same for humans. The same scientists have wondered if the same processes govern all of our liking and wanting, but this question remains unresolved.

Most Hedonists who describe pleasure as intrinsically valuable experience believe that pleasure is internal and conscious. Hedonists who define pleasure in this way may be either Quantitative or Qualitative Hedonists, depending on whether they think that quality is a relevant dimension of how intrinsically valuable we find certain experiences.

d. Pleasure as Pro-Attitude

One of the most recent developments in modern hedonism is the rise of defining pleasure as a pro-attitude – a positive psychological stance toward some object. Any account of Prudential Hedonism that defines pleasure as a pro-attitude is referred to as Attitudinal Hedonism because it is a person’s attitude that dictates whether anything has intrinsic value. Positive psychological stances include approving of something, thinking it is good, and being pleased about it. The object of the positive psychological stance could be a physical object, such as a painting one is observing, but it could also be a thought, such as “my country is not at war,” or even a sensation. An example of a pro-attitude towards a sensation could be being pleased about the fact that an ice cream tastes so delicious.

Fred Feldman, the leading proponent of Attitudinal Hedonism, argues that the sensation of pleasure only has instrumental value – it only brings about value if you also have a positive psychological stance toward that sensation. In addition to his basic Intrinsic Attitudinal Hedonism, which is a form of Quantitative Hedonism, Feldman has also developed many variants that are types of Qualitative Hedonism. For example, Desert-Adjusted Intrinsic Attitudinal Hedonism, which reduces the intrinsic value a pro-attitude has for our well-being based on the quality of deservedness (that is, on the extent to which the particular object deserves a pro-attitude or not). For example, Desert-Adjusted Intrinsic Attitudinal Hedonism might stipulate that sensations of pleasure arising from adulterous behavior do not deserve approval, and so assign them no value.

Defining pleasure as a pro-attitude, while maintaining that all sensations of pleasure have no intrinsic value, makes Attitudinal Hedonism less obviously hedonistic as the versions that define pleasure as a sensation. Indeed, defining pleasure as a pro-attitude runs the risk of creating a preference satisfaction account of well-being because being pleased about something without feeling any pleasure seems hard to distinguish from having a preference for that thing.

5. Contemporary Objections

a. Pleasure is Not the Only Source of Intrinsic Value

The most common argument against Prudential Hedonism is that pleasure is not the only thing that intrinsically contributes to well-being. Living in reality, finding meaning in life, producing noteworthy achievements, building and maintaining friendships, achieving perfection in certain domains, and living in accordance with religious or moral laws are just some of the other things thought to intrinsically add value to our lives. When presented with these apparently valuable aspects of life, Hedonists usually attempt to explain their apparent value in terms of pleasure. A Hedonist would argue, for example, that friendship is not valuable in and of itself, rather it is valuable to the extent that it brings us pleasure. Furthermore, to answer why we might help a friend even when it harms us, a Hedonist will argue that the prospect of future pleasure from receiving reciprocal favors from our friend, rather than the value of friendship itself, should motivate us to help in this way.

Those who object to Prudential Hedonism on the grounds that pleasure is not the only source of intrinsic value use two main strategies. In the first strategy, objectors make arguments that some specific value cannot be reduced to pleasure. In the second strategy, objectors cite very long lists of apparently intrinsically valuable aspects of life and then challenge hedonists with the prolonged and arduous task of trying to explain how the value of all of them can be explained solely by reference to pleasure and the avoidance of pain. This second strategy gives good reason to be a pluralist about value because the odds seem to be against any monistic theory of value, such as Prudential Hedonism. The first strategy, however, has the ability to show that Prudential Hedonism is false, rather than being just unlikely to be the best theory of well-being.

The most widely cited argument for pleasure not being the only source of intrinsic value is based on Robert Nozick’s experience machine thought-experiment. Nozick’s experience machine thought-experiment was designed to show that more than just our experiences matter to us because living in reality also matters to us. This argument has proven to be so convincing that nearly every single book on ethics that discusses hedonism rejects it using only this argument or this one and one other.

In the thought experiment, Nozick asks us to imagine that we have the choice of plugging in to a fantastic machine that flawlessly provides an amazing mix of experiences. Importantly, this machine can provide these experiences in a way that, once plugged in to the machine, no one can tell that their experiences are not real. Disregarding considerations about responsibilities to others and the problems that would arise if everyone plugged in, would you plug in to the machine for life? The vast majority of people reject the choice to live a much more pleasurable life in the machine, mostly because they agree with Nozick that living in reality seems to be important for our well-being. Opinions differ on what exactly about living in reality is so much better for us than the additional pleasure of living in the experience machine, but the most common response is that a life that is not lived in reality is pointless or meaningless.

Since this argument has been used so extensively (from the mid 1970’s onwards) to dismiss Prudential Hedonism, several attempts have been made to refute it. Most commonly, Hedonists argue that living an experience machine life would be better than living a real life and that most people are simply mistaken to not want to plug in. Some go further and try to explain why so many people choose not to plug in. Such explanations often point out that the most obvious reasons for not wanting to plug in can be explained in terms of expected pleasure and avoidance of pain. For example, it might be argued that we expect to get pleasure from spending time with our real friends and family, but we do not expect to get as much pleasure from the fake friends or family we might have in the experience machine. These kinds of attempts to refute the experience machine objection do little to persuade non-Hedonists that they have made the wrong choice.

A more promising line of defence for the Prudential Hedonists is to provide evidence that there is a particular psychological bias that affects most people’s choice in the experience machine thought experiment. A reversal of Nozick’s thought experiment has been argued to reveal just such a bias. Imagine that a credible source tells you that you are actually in an experience machine right now. You have no idea what reality would be like. Given the choice between having your memory of this conversation wiped and going to reality, what would be best for you to choose? Empirical evidence on this choice shows that most people would choose to stay in the experience machine. Comparing this result with how people respond to Nozick’s experience machine thought experiment reveals the following: In Nozick’s experience machine thought experiment people tend to choose a real and familiar life over a more pleasurable life and in the reversed experience machine thought experiment people tend to choose a familiar life over a real life. Familiarity seems to matter more than reality, undermining the strength of Nozick’s original argument. The bias thought to be responsible for this difference is the status quo bias – an irrational preference for the familiar or for things to stay as they are.

Regardless of whether Nozick’s experience machine thought experiment is as decisive a refutation of Prudential Hedonism as it is often thought to be, the wider argument (that living in reality is valuable for our well-being) is still a problem for Prudential Hedonists. That our actions have real consequences, that our friends are real, and that our experiences are genuine seem to matter for most of us regardless of considerations of pleasure. Unfortunately, we lack a trusted methodology for discerning if these things should matter to us. Perhaps the best method for identifying intrinsically valuable aspects of lives is to compare lives that are equal in pleasure and all other important ways, except that one aspect of one of the lives is increased. Using this methodology, however, seems certain to lead to an artificial pluralist conclusion about what has value. This is because any increase in a potentially valuable aspect of our lives will be viewed as a free bonus. And, most people will choose the life with the free bonus just in case it has intrinsic value, not necessarily because they think it does have intrinsic value.

b. Some Pleasure is Not Valuable

The main traditional line of criticism against Prudential Hedonism is that not all pleasure is valuable for well-being, or at least that some pleasures are less valuable than others because of non-amount-related factors. Some versions of this criticism are much easier for Prudential Hedonists to deal with than others depending on where the allegedly disvaluable aspect of the pleasure resides. If the disvaluable aspect is experienced with the pleasure itself, then both Qualitative and Quantitative varieties of Prudential Hedonism have sufficient answers to these problems. If, however, the disvaluable aspect of the pleasure is never experienced, then all types of Prudential Hedonism struggle to explain why the allegedly disvaluable aspect is irrelevant.

Examples of the easier criticisms to deal with are that Prudential Hedonism values, or at least overvalues, perverse and base pleasures. These kinds of criticisms tend to have had more sway in the past and doubtless encouraged Mill to develop his Qualitative Hedonism. In response to the charge that Prudential Hedonism mistakenly values pleasure from sadistic torture, sating hunger, copulating, listening to opera, and philosophising all equally, Qualitative Hedonists can simply deny that it does. Since pleasure from sadistic torture will normally be experienced as containing the quality of sadism (just as the pleasure from listening to good opera is experienced as containing the quality of acoustic excellence), the Qualitative Hedonist can plausibly claim to be aware of the difference in quality and allocate less value to perverse or base pleasures accordingly.

Prudential Hedonists need not relinquish the Quantitative aspect of their theory in order to deal with these criticisms, however. Quantitative Hedonists, can simply point out that moral or cultural values are not necessarily relevant to well-being because the investigation of well-being aims to understand what the good life for the one living it is and what intrinsically makes their life go better for them. A Quantitative Hedonist can simply respond that a sadist that gets sadistic pleasure from torturing someone does improve their own well-being (assuming that the sadist never feels any negative emotions or gets into any other trouble as a result). Similarly, a Quantitative Hedonist can argue that if someone genuinely gets a lot of pleasure from porcine company and wallowing in the mud, but finds opera thoroughly dull, then we have good reason to think that having to live in a pig sty would be better for her well-being than forcing her to listen to opera.

Much more problematic for both Quantitative and Qualitative Hedonists, however, are the more modern versions of the criticism that not all pleasure is valuable. The modern versions of this criticism tend to use examples in which the disvaluable aspect of the pleasure is never experienced by the person whose well-being is being evaluated. The best example of these modern criticisms is a thought experiment devised by Shelly Kagan. Kagan’s deceived businessman thought experiment is widely thought to show that pleasures of a certain kind, namely false pleasures, are worth much less than true pleasures.

Kagan asks us to imagine the life of a very successful businessman who takes great pleasure in being respected by his colleagues, well-liked by his friends, and loved by his wife and children until the day he died. Then Kagan asks us to compare this life with one of equal length and the same amount of pleasure (experienced as coming from exactly the same sources), except that in each case the businessman is mistaken about how those around him really feel. This second (deceived) businessman experiences just as much pleasure from the respect of his colleagues and the love of his family as the first businessman. The only difference is that the second businessman has many false beliefs. Specifically, the deceived businessman’s colleagues actually think he is useless, his wife doesn’t really love him, and his children are only nice to him so that he will keep giving them money. Given that the deceived businessman never knew of any of these deceptions and his experiences were never negatively impacted by the deceptions indirectly, which life do you think is better?

Nearly everyone thinks that the deceived businessman has a worse life. This is a problem for Prudential Hedonists because the pleasure is quantitatively equal in each life, so they should be equally good for the one living it. Qualitative Hedonism does not seem to be able to avoid this criticism either because the falsity of the pleasures experienced by the deceived businessman is a dimension of the pleasure that he never becomes aware of. Theoretically, an externalist and qualitative version of Attitudinal Hedonism could include the falsity dimension of an instance of pleasure even if the falsity dimension never impacts the consciousness of the person. However, the resulting definition of pleasure bears little resemblance to what we commonly understand pleasure to be and also seems to be ad hoc in its inclusion of the truth dimension but not others. A dedicated Prudential Hedonist of any variety can always stubbornly stick to the claim that the lives of the two businessmen are of equal value, but that will do little to convince the vast majority to take Prudential Hedonism more seriously.

c. There is No Coherent and Unifying Definition of Pleasure

Another major line of criticism used against Prudential Hedonists is that they have yet to come up with a meaningful definition of pleasure that unifies the seemingly disparate array of pleasures while remaining recognisable as pleasure. Some definitions lack sufficient detail to be informative about what pleasure actually is, or why it is valuable, and those that do offer enough detail to be meaningful are faced with two difficult tasks.

The first obstacle for a useful definition of pleasure for hedonism is to unify all of the diverse pleasures in a reasonable way. Phenomenologically, the pleasure from reading a good book is very different to the pleasure from bungee jumping, and both of these pleasures are very different to the pleasure of having sex. This obstacle is unsurpassable for most versions of Quantitative Hedonism because it makes the value gained from different pleasures impossible to compare. Not being able to compare different types of pleasure results in being unable to say if a life is better than another in most even vaguely realistic cases. Furthermore, not being able to compare lives means that Quantitative Hedonism could not be usefully used to guide behavior since it cannot instruct us on which life to aim for.

Attempts to resolve the problem of unifying the different pleasures while remaining within a framework of Quantitative Hedonism, usually involve pointing out something that is constant in all of the disparate pleasures and defining that particular thing as pleasure. When pleasure is defined as a strict sensation, this strategy fails because introspection reveals that no such sensation exists. Pleasure defined as the experience of liking or as a pro-attitude does much better at unifying all of the diverse pleasures. However, defining pleasure in these ways makes the task of filling in the details of the theory a fine balancing act. Liking or pro-attitudes must be described in such a way that they are not solely a sensation or best described as a preference satisfaction theory. And they must perform this balancing act while still describing a scientifically plausible and conceptually coherent account of pleasure. Most attempts to define pleasure as liking or pro-attitudes seem to disagree with either the folk conception of what pleasure is or any of the plausible scientific conceptions of how pleasure functions.

Most varieties of Qualitative Hedonism do better at dealing with the problem of diverse pleasures because they can evaluate different pleasures according to their distinct qualities. Qualitative Hedonists still need a coherent method for comparing the different pleasures with each other in order to be more than just an abstract theory of well-being, however. And, it is difficult to construct such a methodology in a way that avoids counter examples, while still describing a scientifically plausible and conceptually coherent account of pleasure.

The second obstacle is creating a definition of pleasure that retains at least some of the core properties of the common understanding of the term ‘pleasure’. As mentioned, many of the potential adjustments to the main definitions of pleasure are useful for avoiding one or more of the many objections against Prudential Hedonism. The problem with this strategy is that the more adjustments that are made, the more apparent it becomes that the definition of pleasure is not recognisable as the pleasure that gave Hedonism its distinctive intuitive plausibility in the first place. When an instance of pleasure is defined simply as when someone feels good, its intrinsic value for well-being is intuitively obvious. However, when the definition of pleasure is stretched, so as to more effectively argue that all valuable experiences are pleasurable, it becomes much less recognisable as the concept of pleasure we use in day-to-day life and its intrinsic value becomes much less intuitive.

6. The Future of Hedonism

The future of hedonism seems bleak. The considerable number and strength of the arguments against Prudential Hedonism’s central principle (that pleasure and only pleasure intrinsically contributes positively to well-being and the opposite for pain) seem insurmountable. Hedonists have been creative in their definitions of pleasure so as to avoid these objections, but more often than not find themselves defending a theory that is not particularly hedonistic, realistic or both.

Perhaps the only hope that Hedonists of all types can have for the future is that advances in cognitive science will lead to a better understanding of how pleasure works in the brain and how biases affect our judgements about thought experiments. If our improved understanding in these areas confirms a particular theory about what pleasure is and also provides reasons to doubt some of the widespread judgements about the thought experiments that make the vast majority of philosophers reject hedonism, then hedonism might experience at least a partial revival. The good news for Hedonists is that at least some emerging theories and results from cognitive science do appear to support some aspects of hedonism.

7. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

• Bentham, Jeremy (1789). An Introduction to the Principles of Morals and Legislation, First printed in 1780 and first published in 1789. A corrected edition with extra footnotes and paragraphs at the end was published in 1823. Recent edition: Adamant Media Corporation, 2005.
  • Bentham’s main discussion of his Quantitative Hedonistic Utilitarianism.
• Blake, R. M. (1926). Why Not Hedonism? A Protest, International Journal of Ethics, 37(1): 1-18.
  • An excellent refutation of G. E. Moore’s main arguments against hedonism.
• Crisp, Roger (2006). Reasons and the Good, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Discusses the importance of ultimate reasons and argues that the best of these do not use moral concepts. The volume also defends Prudential Hedonism, especially Chapter 4.
• Crisp, R. (2006). Hedonism Reconsidered, Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, LXXIII(3): 619-645.
  • Essentially the same as Chapter 4 from his Reasons and the Good.
• De Brigard, F. (2010). If You Like it, Does it Matter if it’s Real?, Philosophical Psychology, 23(1): 43-57.
  • Presents empirical evidence that the experience machine thought experiment is heavily affected by a psychological bias.
• Feldman, Fred (1997). Utilitarianism, Hedonism, and Desert: Essays in Moral Philosophy, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Contains a mixture of topics relevant to hedonism, including modern and ancient theories and objections. There is a detailed section on adjusting pleasure to take deservedness into account (Part III).
• Feldman, Fred (2004). Pleasure and the Good Life, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • The best and most detailed account of Attitudinal Hedonism. This volume also includes a very detailed account of how Prudential Hedonism should be defined.
• Kagan, Shelly (1998). Chapter 2: The Good, in his Normative Ethics, Oxford: Westview Press, pp. 25-69.
  • See especially pp. 34-36 for the first discussion of the Deceived Businessman thought experiment.
• Kawall, J. (1999). The Experience Machine and Mental State Theories of Well-being, The Journal of Value Inquiry, 33: 381-387.
  • An excellent article about the strengths and weaknesses of the experience machine thought experiment as it is used against hedonism.
• Kringelbach, Morten L. & Berridge, Kent B. (eds.) (2010). Pleasures of the Brain, Oxford University Press.
  • This edited volume collects papers from the leading experts on pleasure from the disciplines of psychology and neuroscience. Perhaps of most value is a chapter at the front of the book in which the experts all answer a standard set of questions posed by the editors. The questions include: “Is pleasure necessarily a conscious feeling?”, “Is pleasure simply a sensation, like sweetness?”, and “Is there a common currency for all sensory pleasures… [o]r are different sensory pleasures mediated by different neural circuits?” The experts answers to these questions is the perfect starting point for a philosopher looking to find out more about pleasure from cognitive science.
• Mill, John Stuart (1861). Utilitarianism, Indianapolis: Bobbs-Merrill, 1957.
  • Mill’s main discussion of his Qualitative Hedonistic Utilitarianism.
• Moore, George E. (1903). Principia Ethica, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • See especially Chapter 3 on hedonism, which contains Moore’s influential arguments against hedonism.
• Nozick, R. (1974). Anarchy, State, and Utopia, Oxford: Blackwell, 1991.
  • See especially pp. 42-45 for the first discussion of the experience machine thought experiment.
• Plato (1937). Philebus, in The Dialogues of Plato, trans. by B. Jowett, New York: Random House.
  • See especially Part ii, p. 353 for the oyster example.
• Plato (1974). Book II: Preliminaries, in The Republic, trans. by Desmond Lee, second edition (revised), Penguin Books, 1983.
  • Original discussion of the Ring of Gyges example.
• Sobel, D. (1999). Pleasure as a Mental State, Utilitas, 11(2): 230-234.
  • Argues against the viability of defining pleasure as intrinsically valuable experience.
• Sobel, D. (2002). Varieties of Hedonism, Journal of Social Philosophy, 33(2): 240-256.
  • Describes some of the main types of Prudential Hedonism and the problems with them.
• Tännsjö, T. (1998). Hedonistic Utilitarianism, Edinburgh University Press.
  • Tännsjö endorses unconscious pleasures as being valuable, an unusual contemporary position. This book can be difficult to acquire.
• Tännsjö, T. (2007). Narrow Hedonism, Journal of Happiness Studies, 8:79-98.
  • Worth a look if you do not have access to his Hedonistic Utilitarianism.
• Weijers, D. (2011). Intuitive Biases in Judgements about Thought Experiments: The Experience Machine Revisited, Philosophical Writings, 50 & 51.
  • An explanation of how psychological biases can affect our judgements about thought experiments using the experience machine thought experiment as an example.

b. Secondary and Mixed Sources

• Gunaratna. Tarkarahasyadīpika. Cārvāka/Lokāyata: an Anthology of Source Materials and Some Recent Studies. Ed. Debiprasad Chattopadhyaya. New Delhi: Indian Council of Philosophical Research in association with Rddhi-India Calcutta, 1990.
  • An anthology of primary source materials on the Cārvāka with some more recent analysis.
• Inwood, B., & Gerson, L. P. (eds.) (1994). The Epicurus Reader: Selected Writings and Testimonia. Indianapolis, Hackett Publishing.
  • An inexpensive collection that has most of the major extant writings of Epicurus, in addition to other ancient sources such as Cicero and Plutarch who wrote about Epicureanism. However, there is little commentary or explication of the material, and some of the primary sources are fairly opaque. Unusually, the writing of Lucretius does not feature much in this collection.
• Laertius, Diogenes (1925) Aristippus, in Volume I, Book II of his Lives of the Philosophers, trans. by R. D. Hicks, The Loeb Classical Library, Harvard University Press.
• Laertius, Diogenes (1925) Epicurus, in Volume II, Book X of Lives of Eminent Philosophers, trans. by R. D. Hicks, The Loeb Classical Library, Harvard University Press.
• Mitsis, Phillip (1988). Epicurus’ Ethical Theory: The Pleasures of Invulnerability, Ithaca: Cornell University Press.
  • Covers all of the major areas of Epicurean ethics, from pleasure, to friendship, justice, and human freedom. Mitsis is especially good at showing how Epicurus’ conception of pleasure differs from that of the more modern Utilitarians.
• O’Keefe, Tim (2002). The Cyrenaics on Pleasure, Happiness, and Future-Concern, Phronesis, 47(4), pp. 395-416.
  • Explores the question of why the Cyrenaics, alone among ancient Greek ethical theorists, claim that happiness is not the highest good, but particular pleasures are instead, and that one should not worry about the long-term consequences of one’s actions but instead concentrate on obtaining pleasures that are near at hand.
• Smith, James and Sosa, Ernest (eds.) (1969). Mill’s Utilitarianism: Text and Criticism, Belmont CA: Wadsworth.
  • A great collection of Mill’s writing and commentaries on it by Mill scholars. The volume also includes an extensive section on suggested further reading. The Further reading section is helpfully broken down by which of Mill’s essays they are most relevant to.
• West, Henry R. (ed.) (2006). The Blackwell Guide to Mill’s Utilitarianism, Oxford: Blackwell.
  • A collection of essays on different aspects of Mill’s Hedonistic Utilitarianism and the relevant original passages from Mill. See especially Chapter 4, Wendy Donner’s article, Mill’s Theory of Value.

Author Information

Dan Weijers
Email: danweijers@gmail.com
Victoria University of Wellington
New Zealand

Surveillance Ethics

Surveillance involves paying close and sustained attention to another person. It is distinct from casual yet focused people-watching, such as might occur at a pavement cafe, to the extent that it is sustained over time. Furthermore the design is not to pay attention to just anyone, but to pay attention to some entity (a person or group) in particular and for a particular reason. Nor does surveillance have to involve watching. It may also involve listening, as when a telephone conversation is bugged, or even smelling, as in the case of dogs trained to discover drugs, or hardware which is able to discover explosives at a distance.

The ethics of surveillance considers the moral aspects of how surveillance is employed. Is it a value-neutral activity which may be used for good or ill, or is it always problematic and if so why? What are the benefits and harms of surveillance? Who is entitled to carry out surveillance, when and under what circumstances? Are there any circumstances under which someone should never be under surveillance?

This article provides a brief overview of the history of surveillance ethics, beginning with Jeremy Bentham and George Orwell. It then looks at the development of surveillance studies in the light of Michel Foucault and the challenges posed by new techniques of surveillance which allow unprecedented collection and retention of information. The bulk of this article focuses on considering the ethical challenges posed by surveillance. These include why surveillance is undertaken and by whom, as well as when and how it may be employed. This is followed by an examination of a number of concerns regarding the impact of surveillance such as social sorting, distance and chilling effects.

Table of Contents

1. Origins
2. Recent History
3. Privacy
4. Trust and Autonomy
5. Cause
6. Authority
7. Necessity
8. Means
9. Social Sorting
10. Function Creep
11. Distance
12. Chilling Effects
13. Power
14. References and Further Reading

1. Origins

Jeremy Bentham’s idea of the Panopticon is arguably the first significant reference to surveillance ethics in the modern period (Bentham 1995). The Panopticon was to be a prison, comprising a circular building with the cells adjacent to the outside walls. In the centre was a tower in which the prison supervisor would live and monitor the inmates. Large external windows and smaller internal windows in each cell would allow the supervisor to monitor the activities of the inmates, while a system of louvres in the central tower would prevent the inmates from seeing the supervisor. A rudimentary form of directed loudspeaker would enable the supervisor to communicate with the prisoners. Through not knowing when they were under surveillance, Bentham argued, the inmates would come to assume that they were always under surveillance. This would encourage them to be self-disciplined and well-behaved during their incarceration. The prospect of living in this way would also deter those who visited the prison from wanting to commit crimes. Hence the Panopticon would serve as a deterrent to the inmates from misbehaving or committing future crimes and to general society from committing crimes and finding themselves so incarcerated.

George Orwell’s 1984 extended the Panopticon to encompass the whole of society, or at least the middle classes (Orwell 2004). In this novel the Panopticon became electrical with the invention of the telescreen, a two-way television which allowed the state almost total visual and auditory access to the homes, streets and workplaces of the citizens. As the inmates of the Panopticon were reminded of the supervisor’s presence by the loudspeaker, so citizens in Orwell’s vision were told repeatedly that “Big Brother is watching you”. Orwell used the novel to discuss, among other things, both the reasons of the state for wanting ubiquitous surveillance and the impact that this has on the individual and the nature of a society under ubiquitous surveillance.

The theme of the Panopticon was revisited by Michel Foucault in Discipline and Punish, an overview of the history of prisons and the value they serve (Foucault 1991). Foucault’s particular concern was with the use of power and its increasing bureaucratization in the modern period. His study began with torture and the emphasis on the sovereignty and power of the king. With the Enlightenment the prison was introduced as a more efficient means of punishment, supported by society’s increasing acceptance of the value of discipline beyond merely the military or religious arenas. Oversight became a fundamental tool in enforcing discipline, and so the Panopticon served as both a means of punishment and a form of discipline of the inmates, owing to the seemingly persistent gaze of the supervisor. With time, Foucault argued, the prison was combined with the workhouse and the hospital to simultaneously deprive inmates of their freedom whilst attempting to discipline and reform them.

Aside from Foucault’s comments on the nature of prisons and their value in society, his reference to the Panopticon introduced the concept to a new generation of scholars unfamiliar with Bentham’s penal theories. As such it is the Panopticon read through the lens of Foucault, along with Orwell’s dystopian vision, that came to dominate early discussions of surveillance and its impact on society and the individual.

2. Recent History

While Bentham/Foucault and Orwell successfully raised questions about the value and harms of surveillance, these had limited impact in many philosophy departments. As such there is little written on the ethics of surveillance from a strictly philosophical perspective. However, the interest sparked by Foucault, coupled with recent advances in technology, has led to a questioning of the role surveillance plays in contemporary society. This questioning has been increasingly reflected in academia with the creation of the inter-disciplinary field of Surveillance Studies, bringing together sociologists, jurists, political scientists, geographers, and increasingly philosophers, to consider issues connected with and arising from surveillance.

Although there may be a degree of continuity with earlier forms of surveillance, the “new surveillance” (Marx 1998) introduced by technological advances adds degrees of complexity and mobility with which society has not been faced before. Closed Circuit Television (CCTV) cameras offer a potentially ubiquitous gaze and a hidden, anonymous watcher akin to the Panopticon on a hitherto unimaginable scale. Wireless networks transmit vast quantities of information on systems vulnerable to intercept. The Internet has seen the creation of virtual identities, “data doubles” – reflections of the “real” person in cyberspace – which are vulnerable to abuse and theft; online storing of medical, banking and other personal data which may be hacked or simply lost by the institution responsible; and the increased commodification of personal information by web sites which sell that data to advertising companies or governments. In each of these cases not only are the technology and services offered new but the nature of the technology means that almost limitless information can be collected, stored indefinitely and returned to or searched at will.

Taken together these issues have moved on the discussion from analogies drawn with the Panopticon or 1984. While each maintains rhetorical force, the computerization of society has rendered them limited in their ability to capture the complexities of contemporary surveillance, still less the benefits and harms that it can bring. Furthermore, both the Panopticon and Big Brother are authoritarian and negative images which lend weight to the suggestion that surveillance is always unethical or problematic. However, this is not the case. There are instances in which surveillance can be not only justified but even embraced by the surveilled. Surveillance is itself an ethically neutral concept. What determines the ethical nature of a particular instance of surveillance will be the considerations which follow, such as justified cause, the means employed, and questions of proportionality. Before turning to these, however, we will discuss the areas of life most impacted by surveillance: Privacy, trust and autonomy.

3. Privacy

One of the core arguments against surveillance is that it poses a threat to privacy, which is of value to the individual and to society. This raises a number of questions about privacy, what it is and to what extent and why it is valuable.

Much of the early work on privacy was carried out in the legal realm, particularly in the United States. Warren and Brandeis’ The Right to Privacy (Warren and Brandeis 1890) is generally taken as the first attempt to define the concept of privacy. Here the authors claim that the right to privacy is an instance of the “right to be let alone” and establish limits to that right, arguing that it is not absolute. Developments in technology then gave rise to defining legal cases, such as Katz v. United States (1967) which related privacy and surveillance to the Fourth Amendment of the US Constitution (forbidding unreasonable search and seizure by the state). Eisenstadt v. Baird (1972) then established that the right to privacy involved the right to make important choices without government intervention, drawing a connection between privacy and autonomy. This was drawn upon in Roe vs. Wade (1972) to argue for a woman’s rights in abortion.

In the aftermath of these legal decisions the concept of privacy was increasingly debated by philosophers. Judith Jarvis Thomson (Thomson 1975) argued that the right to privacy consists of a cluster of rights which overlap with both property rights and rights of the person. She held that there are no privacy rights which do not overlap with clusters of other rights, and so there is no distinct right to privacy. A violation of someone’s right to privacy only occurs when one of these other rights has also been violated in a relevant manner. Hence the illicit viewing of another’s diary involves a breach of his right to dispose of his property as he sees fit; extracting information through torture involves a violation of someone’s right not to be injured. In both cases there is a violation of a person’s privacy, but this is only because other, more fundamental rights have been violated.

Thomas Scanlon (Scanlon 1975) responded by arguing that Thomson’s analysis was convoluted and counter-intuitive. Instead he proposed that we have socially-defined zones of privacy which enable us to act with the assumption that we are not being monitored. These zones are motivated by our interest in not having to be alert to specific observation at all times. James Rachels (Rachels 1975), responding to both Thomson and Scanlon, argued that privacy was rather a matter of relationships. In defining our relationships with others, we use varying degrees of privacy to establish intimacy. With a stranger we uphold a high degree of privacy, whilst with a close family member we may have and expect much less privacy. Indeed, he argued, what it means to be a friend is for the relationship to involve less privacy than would otherwise be the case.

More recently W.A. Parent (Parent 1983) argued that privacy involved the control of undocumented information about oneself. This has been contested by Jeffrey Reimann (Reiman 2004) and Tony Doyle (Doyle 2009), who hold that privacy is not restricted to information. A porn star whose body is freely available for all to see may still have his or her privacy violated if spied upon in his or her own home. Daniel Nathan (Nathan 1990) and Danah Boyd (Boyd 2010) agree with Parent that control is an important issue, while Herman Tavani and James Moor (Tavani and Moor 2001) hold that privacy relates more accurately to the access another has to me than to who controls the information about me.

Despite the disagreements, most would agree that on an individual level, privacy affords us the space to be ourselves and to define ourselves through giving us a degree of autonomy and protecting our dignity. In our interactions with others we may define the intimacy of our relationships with them through the amount of privacy we relinquish in that relationship. As we engage with society at large we gain confidence and security from our privacy, safe that those we do not know do not in turn know all about us. We fear the stranger and what they might do if they knew our vulnerabilities. Through keeping those vulnerabilities private, we maintain a level of personal safety.

Privacy is also of value to society at large. As noted, we may appear in public safe in the knowledge that our weaknesses are not on display for all to see, allowing for confident personal interaction. When we vote we do so in the belief that no-one can see our decision and treat us well or poorly in the light of how we voted. Privacy is thus important in the social context of democracy. In many cases we do not want to know everything about everyone around us and so privacy can protect the rest of us from being exposed to too much information. Thanks to a level of anonymity I may also feel emboldened to speak out publicly against corruption or injustice, or simply to be more creative in self-expression. Many of these benefits can be seen through the contrast with states employing high levels of surveillance, such as the former German Democratic Republic. Here the surveillance carried out by the Ministerium für Staatssicherheit (Stasi) was instrumental in quashing open dissent and enforcing the behavioural uniformity foreseen by Orwell (Funder 2004).

There is also of a tension between the safety of the individual as granted by his or her privacy, and the safety of the community which comes from denying the individual his or her privacy. On the most basic level, I feel safest if you know nothing about me but I know everything about you. This is reversed from your perspective, leading to the tension of balancing privacy against security. This balance suggests that it may be morally justifiable to deny one person’s privacy in the interests of the security of the community, although it is by no means always clear when these situations might arise.

4. Trust and Autonomy

Linked closely to the issue of privacy is that of trust. As highlighted by Rachels (Rachels 1975), privacy is often held in an inverse relationship to trust such that the more trust exists between two people, the less need there is for privacy. This is not universally true as intimate partners may still lock the bathroom door. Nonetheless committed relationships are often marked by a higher degree of trust and a reduced level of privacy. When one of those elements is breached, either through intruding on (limited) privacy or through a breaking of trust, the relationship is damaged. One reflection of diminished trust in a relationship is increased surveillance, as when suspicious partners hire private investigators to determine an infidelity. Conversely, the discovery of increased surveillance, especially when the surveilled party is innocent, may also lead to decreased levels of trust. At a personal level trust is often reciprocal: Why should I trust you if you don’t trust me? The discovery of surveillance could well therefore damage personal relationships.

Surveillance also limits the opportunity to present oneself in the manner of one’s own choosing. It is hence limiting on the individual’s autonomy, impacting how that individual interacts with the world. While Bentham believed the Panopticon would encourage inmates to self-discipline, this would only occur through fear of repercussions. The inmates would be denied the opportunity to demonstrate willingness to reform without the surveillance. There would therefore be no opportunities for the supervisor of the prison to place his trust in the prisoner, nor for that prisoner to demonstrate his trustworthiness other than in the presence of surveillance. Any traits displayed would then arguably not be genuine reflections of the character of the inmate. The same is true of surveillance in the workplace, schools and society at large. If the surveilled is suspicious of or conscious of the surveillance then they might conform to the expected norm, but this will not necessarily reflect their character.

Surveillance therefore diminishes the need to trust the surveilled person. Its presence will pressure that person to conform and so render his actions more predictable. Furthermore, as in the Panopticon, if he does not conform there is the chance he will be subject to sanctions. Surveilled people therefore can become more predictable if they fear reprisals for acting in ways that merit the disapproval of the surveillant. In that sense they are therefore more trustworthy (an authority can trust that they will act in such a manner). If the purpose of surveillance is to control or deter people, then surveillance of which the subject is aware could be effective. If, on the other hand, the purpose is to assess the character of people as that character is expressed in integrity, then surveillance of which the subject is aware will be of little help.

We have seen the impacts of surveillance on privacy, trust and autonomy. We are now in a position to consider when surveillance may be justified in spite of (or because of) those impacts.

5. Cause

The purpose of surveillance, or one particular instantiation of surveillance, is probably the most fundamental ethical question that can be asked on this subject. We may think of security as an obvious response, especially as it concerns state surveillance in the form of espionage, or in the form of security cameras surrounding particular buildings. In a sense this throws the question back one degree to ask whether security, or this degree of security, is justified under the circumstances. This will then hinge in part on who it is that is carrying out the surveillance and in part on whom they are monitoring. Is state surveillance of political dissidents, for instance, really necessary for state security?

Security isn’t the only use of surveillance, however. Many retail establishments use surveillance for the mutual benefit of themselves and their customers. Loyalty cards in supermarkets enable the stores to see who is buying which goods and build up detailed pictures of their customer base. Customers participate in this surveillance in return for exclusive deals. Frequent users receive special offers either to widen their shopping experience or to encourage loyalty to the particular store.

Efficiency savings such as these are not limited to retail. They also apply on public and private transport when smart cards enable a person to use the subway or a toll road without using cash. They can aid the rapid transfer of information regarding a person’s health if they fall ill or have an accident when away from home. Security and customer benefit may also come together as, for example, when credit cards are suspended following atypical spending habits of the user. This might also be the case if law enforcement agencies find that they need to establish an alibi or build a profile of a suspect.

Finally there is the possibility of using surveillance for personal gain. This might be financial or emotional, but can extend to other reasons. An unethical computer hacker might break into a website to steal credit card numbers which she can then use for her own ends. Alternatively a Peeping Tom might steal up to someone’s window with voyeuristic intent, or an ex-spouse might seek to gain incriminating information in order to secure custody of their child (Allen 2008).

While issues of simple personal gain which involve violating the privacy of another seem to be unacceptable, although there might be exceptions, questions of security and efficiency are less clear-cut. Many choose to opt-in to supermarket or transport surveillance precisely for the benefits that these systems offer, despite the intensely personal knowledge of the customer that the store can gain from these interactions. In the case of state security the questions often fall along the lines of how far should the privacy of the few be sacrificed for the security of the many. As shall be seen when we come to consider social sorting, however, questions of distribution also arise: Who stands to gain and who to lose from a particular instance of surveillance?

Consent is a major consideration in the justification of surveillance, and particularly the cause of surveillance. If I invite you into my home I am consenting for you to see me in a context which would hitherto have been private and secluded from you. In the popular game show Big Brother contestants consented to being monitored round the clock for up to three months. This does not appear to be problematic from the perspective of the surveillance. As noted above, we do not feel an imposition has occurred if we choose to take up a supermarket’s offer of a loyalty card and the convenience that it brings. We might, however, object strongly if it transpires that the store has been monitoring the spending of individuals without such cards by recording their credit card usage and correlating this with itemised receipts.

While consent can justify surveillance, however, the lack of consent does not automatically thereby invalidate it. Law enforcement does not need to seek the consent of the criminals it wishes to monitor to accumulate evidence against them, nor does the state need to gain consent of those who are genuine threats to its security. As such, we must look to justifiable causes for non-consensual surveillance.

One justification often given for large-scale surveillance is the consequentialist appeal to the greater good. This might apply when the security of the community is best served by monitoring some or all in that community. If the community in question is a state then the numbers involved will be too great to realistically gain complete acceptance of the surveillance by every citizen. As such the state may then appeal to the benefits that will come to more people as a result of the surveillance to justify the imposition.

Deontologists are likely to resist this justification as it implies that the rights of the few may be overridden by the interests of the many. A deontological justification will look rather to the entity to be surveilled and ask what it is about that entity that means it deserves or is in some way liable to be monitored in this way. Given the aforementioned harms of surveillance, there must be a good reason as to why this person or group should be exposed to those harms.

In practice, justifications for surveillance often include both consequentialist and deontological considerations. Hence state security is justified in both protecting the majority and focusing its attention on particular wrongdoers who pose a threat to that majority. Similarly, CCTV in the public square is justified in providing peace of mind to the general public by monitoring all, but targeting only particular individuals or groups who are believed to pose a threat.

The type of surveillance might also have a bearing on whether a consequentialist or  deontological justification is sought. CCTV, which is indiscriminate in whom it monitors, lends itself to a consequentialist perspective. In shopping malls the majority of people surveilled by CCTV have done nothing wrong and have no intention of wrongdoing. Nonetheless, the benefits which CCTV brings in detecting the minority of wrongdoers and punishing them may be taken to justify the surveillance of all. By contrast, a more discriminating form of surveillance, such as tapping a suspect’s telephone, lends itself more to a deontological approach. If a person has given an authority such as the police reasonable suspicion to believe he has committed a crime, so he has rendered himself liable to be monitored in this way.

Finally, differences between deontologists and consequentialists emerge in opposition to surveillance. Deontologists will typically find surveillance less acceptable when it violates certain rights of individuals such as the right to privacy. By contrast, consequentialists will tend to be more sanguine about concerns with individual rights in favour of overall costs and benefits to society. If a particular instance of surveillance can be shown to improve the wellbeing of society, albeit at the cost of the privacy of a few individuals, then consequentialists are less likely to see this as problematic than deontologists.

6. Authority

Much of the justification of surveillance, and particularly the cause of that surveillance, will depend on who it is that is carrying out the surveillance. State security can and should be carried out by state intelligence agencies. By contrast it should not be carried out by journalists or foreign aid workers, who need to maintain a level of neutrality in order to carry out their work effectively. If this is the role of state intelligence agencies then those agencies would not be justified in the surveillance of domestic employers to ensure that they are not abusing their workforce. This should rather be the domain of domestic law enforcement.

State surveillance of genuine enemies of the state is one of the less controversial elements of surveillance. Even here, though, it is important to be clear as to precisely whose security is being guarded: That of the state or of those currently empowered to run the state? When the protests occurred in Tiananmen Square in 1989, were the protestors challenging 1) the security of China, 2) the security of the Communist Party running China or 3) the security of those individuals leading the Communist Part of China? To what extent was China the Communist Party and how much of the identity of the state is tied up with those who run the state?

The decision to employ surveillance does not lie entirely with the state, although the state may chose to regulate the use of surveillance. Employers sometimes monitor their employees, either to prevent theft or whistle-blowing or to ensure that they are working to their maximum ability. Retailers, as noted above, monitor customer spending habits to improve efficiency and sales. Parents monitor sleeping infants so as to respond should the child wake in the night. Private investigators might engage in surveillance to establish infidelity, while Peeping Toms might do so for kicks. While it might be felt that the investigator is justified and the Peeping Tom is not, what of the case when the private investigator is attempting to establish infidelity and simultaneously enjoying his work a little too much?

In each case the ethical authority to carry out surveillance is intimately linked to the justifying cause of that surveillance. Hence an individual is justified in carrying out surveillance of his property if it is to secure the property from theft, but not if it is to spy on his tenants. Parents are justified (indeed, often expected) to monitor their infant children as they sleep, but whether they are also justified in monitoring the babysitter watching over their children is far more controversial. Groups of people are justified in watching their street, particularly if it has been subject to a recent spate of theft, through Neighbourhood Watch schemes, but not in intimidating an unpopular neighbour through persistent overt surveillance. This is not to suggest that intention alone can justify surveillance. A landlord might wish to secure his property by placing a camera in the bathroom (lest a burglar enter through the window). While his intention might not be to spy on his tenants the effect will be precisely that. Similarly, baby monitors left in areas where they are likely to record intimate phone conversations of a babysitter are still an invasion of the babysitter’s privacy, irrespective of the parents’ intentions.

7. Necessity

Necessity is often cited as an important condition for justified surveillance. Article 8 of the European Union Convention on Human Rights, for example, states that “there shall be no interference by a public authority with the exercise of this right [to privacy] except such as is in accordance with the law and is necessary in a democratic society in the interests of national security, public safety or the economic well-being of the country, for the prevention of disorder or crime, for the protection of health or morals, or for the protection of the rights and freedoms of others” (Council of Europe 1950). We shall discuss proportionality and discrimination below. Here we shall focus on what is meant by necessity in the context of surveillance.

When is surveillance necessary, though? Should surveillance, like war, be a matter of last resort? If so, when is that moment of last resort reached?

The concept of necessity can limit surveillance from being undertaken arbitrarily or prematurely. An authority may not monitor anyone at any time. Surveillance must rather be required by the circumstances of the case. However, this is simply to replace “necessary” with “required” and so does not help. We are still left with the question as to when surveillance is required by the circumstances of the case.

John Lango (Lango 2006) has suggested two criteria for necessity: The feasibility standard and the awfulness standard. The first occurs when there is sufficient evidence to suggest that there is no feasible alternative, the second when the alternatives are worse than the proposed course of action. When one of these criteria is met the action may be deemed necessary. Given the harms of surveillance, it should therefore be avoided if there are less harmful alternatives. However, surveillance becomes necessary when either there is no alternative, or when the alternatives such as physical intrusion or arrest are more harmful than the surveillance itself.

8. Means

How surveillance is carried out is a further consideration which should be taken into account. Is the surveillance proportionate to its aim and is it discriminate in whom it targets? Proportionality of action is a familiar concept in legal and military ethics, but it has application to surveillance as well. We might return to the images of Big Brother or the Panopticon to picture scenarios in which surveillance is total and unending, and the horror which this often arouses in our minds. In these cases it is hard to imagine the occasioning justification which would see such surveillance as a proportionate response. Even major wars do not justify the perpetual monitoring of all citizens around the clock.

More recent, non-fictional cases exist in the surveillance of school children through using fingerprinting technology either to grant entrance and egress from the school, or to pay for school lunches. While the former case might be seen as providing protection to the children from those who should not be in the school, the latter seems highly invasive and an extreme manner to respond to playground bullies stealing lunch money or parents’ desire to know what food their children are eating. Similar questions have been raised about the full-body screening of airline passengers which was introduced in 2009 in the US and the UK, leading to monochrome “nude” images of all those who went through the scanners. Irrespective of health concerns associated with the scanners, they were seen by many to be extremely invasive of privacy without offering a concomitant level of security to those flying on the airline.

If proportionality questions the depth, or intrusiveness of surveillance, discrimination considers its breadth. It asks how many people are likely to be monitored as a result of the particular form of surveillance. Some aspects of surveillance, such as wire tapping, are highly discriminating and target only those using the particular phone under observation. Others, such as CCTV in public places, are broadly indiscriminate and collect information about a great number of people, only some of which will be of interest to the surveillant. We may ask if there is an onus on the surveillant to be as discriminating as possible and only collect information or invade the privacy of as few people as absolutely necessary, given the confines of what is reasonably possible.

A related question is whether any form of surveillance should be absolutely prohibited. Possible candidates for impermissible surveillance would be that of public toilets or private bedrooms. However even here it would appear as if there are cases when these might become of critical importance to justifying causes, such as state security. This might occur if a civil servant with access to state secrets is believed to be involved in a sexual liaison with a member of a foreign intelligence agency. Less exotically, an organised crime syndicate might use a public toilet as a dead letter drop for passing drugs, guns or money. In each of these cases it might be felt that the perhaps obvious places for banning surveillance could in fact become legitimate contexts. In these cases, however, it would be important to protect the innocent as much as possible by limiting the intrusion. Film which is not useful as evidence should be promptly deleted; the monitoring of toilets should be carried out by a member of the same sex; and if possible software should be used which grants anonymity to all captured on film by default and can only reveal individual details upon request.

9. Social Sorting

Much of the discussion surrounding the ethics of surveillance concerns threats to individual or group privacy, and the balance of power between the individual and the state or the individual’s employers. There is a further potential harm of surveillance in the form of social sorting (Lyon 2002). The purpose of surveillance, it is argued, is to sort people into categories for ends which are either good or ill. The danger, however, is that social stereotypes are carried over into these categories and may even be enshrined and institutionalized in them. As a result particular forms of surveillance might serve to have real impact on people’s life chances owing to such institutionalized prejudice. For example, a recent study found that CCTV operators were disproportionately monitoring the young, the male and ethnic minorities “for no obvious reason” (Norris & Armstrong 1999). That is, in the absence of suspicious behaviour they were choosing to focus their attention on these categories of people. The result is that anyone falling into these categories is more likely to be caught if doing something wrong than someone else, thus perpetuating the stereotype. Furthermore, as these groups were being watched more frequently than others, they were more likely to be seen as doing something suspicious. This in turn could lead to disproportionate response rates by security forces on the ground, contributing to a sense of alienation and rejection by society.

10. Function Creep

Function creep (Winner 1977) involves extending the use of a technology from the cause for which it was initially intended to a different cause. This is readily seen in the use of identity cards in the UK, introduced in the 1939 National Registration Act for the purposes of security, national service and rationing. By 1950 the same cards were being used by 39 government agencies for reasons as diverse as collecting parcels from the post office to routine police enquiries. While any or even all of these were arguably justified, few could be justified under the terms of the initial Act. It was a combination of protest and the eventual recognition of this extension of use which led to the abolition of the Act that same year.

It is not just an extension of surveillance technology which can count as function creep but also an extension of the information retrieved by that technology. CCTV may be installed in a public transport hub in order to better ease traffic flows and predict suicides in order to facilitate timely intervention. In the event of a terrorist atrocity occurring in that hub, though, the same images can be used to identify the terrorist and the means of carrying out the atrocity. In this way function creep can be seen to be complex in its application: Its new use might be fully justifiable. What is problematic is the application of the technology in a new area in one instance leading to its regular and repeated use in that area, especially when this extension has not been subject to ethical scrutiny.

11. Distance

Surveillance typically puts a distance between the surveillant and the person or group surveilled. This can be of benefit to both as it removes the surveillant from the immediacy of the situation and may provide her with time and space to deliberate before reacting to a situation. It might also mean that she does not feel personally threatened in a situation and so react more calmly than would otherwise be the case. However it also simplifies everyday levels of human interaction such as negotiation, discretion, and the use of subtlety: From the surveillant’s perspective someone is either a target or not, and the surveilled subject is not given a platform to respond. This is a concern which is exacerbated by the automation of surveillance and threat detection as the software operating the surveillance can only see people in these terms. There is a further concern that the distance between operator and subject means that the two might never meet. Yet without personal confrontation an operator with social prejudices may never be challenged in her views. She might never meet a person from an ethnic minority (or not one from the minority of which she is suspicious) and so fail to be challenged in her view that all members of that social group are, by virtue of their membership, inherently worthy of suspicion.

12. Chilling Effects

International law states that people have certain human rights, such as the right to free speech, the right to association and the right to protest (United Nations 1948). Suspicion as to a state’s motives, however, may lead to cynicism as to how the state will employ its surveillance technology in self-protection. Even if there is no evidence of wrong-doing the state may nonetheless choose to keep records on those who publicly confess to a certain belief, or who choose to associate with those whom the state believes pose a threat. These records may then be used against citizens at a later date by the state, or by a future iteration of the state if the individuals running the executive change. The knowledge of the accumulation and possession of these records by the state may disincline some citizens from engaging in these legitimate activities, preferring to keep their heads down and avoid notice by the state. These so-called “chilling effects” are at odds with human rights and democratic practice and can lead to behavioural uniformity and a stifling of creativity. In certain dictatorial regimes this may be seen as advantageous. Again one can return to Orwell’s 1984 for a dystopian vision of chilling effects (see also Funder 2004).

13. Power

Throughout this article there has been a recurring theme of power. Through the act of surveillance the surveillant gains power over the surveilled, either through the gathering of information regarding that person which they would rather keep secret (or, at least, keep control over its distribution), or through distancing the person and treating them as acceptable or unacceptable for whatever is the purpose of that surveillance. The balance of power between individuals, or between individuals and groups such as employers or the state, is therefore an important consideration in assessing what it is that is wrong or dangerous about many forms of surveillance.

If we return to the parental monitoring of infants, the context is one of the empowered over the powerless and the cause of the monitoring is paternal care. As noted, this is often seen as a duty of the parent and so one which is justified. As children grow and become more independent, however, they require less care and gain an increasingly strong claim to their own privacy. This is true of surveillance in general as it transfers power from the surveilled to the surveillant. When consent is given then this is more, although possibly not always, justifiable. In the absence of consent, however, this disempowerment of the individual is highly problematic, threatening their dignity and ultimately their responsibility for their own lives.

14. References and Further Reading

• Allen, A.L. (2008). “The Virtuous Spy: Privacy as an Ethical Limit”, The Monist 91.1: 3-22.
• Bentham, J. (1995). The Panopticon Writings. Verso Books.
• Boyd, D. (2010). “Making Sense of Privacy and Publicity”. SXSW. Austin, Texas, March 13.
• Council of Europe (1950). Convention for the Protection of Human Rights and Fundamental Freedoms as amended by Protocols No. 11 and No. 14.
• Doyle, T. (2009). “Privacy and Perfect Voyeurism”. Ethics and Information Technology 11: 181-189.
• Foucault, M. (1991). Discipline and Punish: The Birth of the Prison new edn., Penguin.
• Funder, A. (2004). Stasiland: Stories from Behind the Berlin Wall new edn., Granta Books.
• Lango, J. (2006). “Last Resort and Coercive Threats: Relating a Just War Principle to a Military Practice”. Joint Services Conference on Professional Ethics.
• Lyon, D. (2002). Surveillance as Social Sorting: Privacy, Risk and Automated Discrimination, Routledge.
• Marx, G.T. (1998). “Ethics for the New Surveillance”. The Information Society 14: 171-185.
• Nathan, D. (1990). “Just Looking: Voyeurism and the Grounds of Privacy”. Public Affairs Quarterly 4.4: 365-386.
• Norris, C. and Armstrong, G. (1999). “CCTV and the Social Structuring of Surveillance”. In K. Painter and N. Tilley, eds. Surveillance of Public Space: CCTV, Street Lighting and Crime Prevention, Crime Prevention Studies, Monsey, New York, Criminal Justice Press: 157-78.
• Orwell, G. (2004). 1984 Nineteen Eighty-Four new edn., Penguin Classics.
• Parent, W.A. (1983). “Privacy, Morality and the Law”. Philosophy and Public Affairs 12.4: 269-288.
• Rachels, J. (1975). “Why Privacy is Important”. Philosophy and Public Affairs 4.4: 323-333.
• Reiman, J. (2004). “Driving to the Panopticon: A Philosophical Exploration of the Risks to Privacy Posted by the Information Technology of the Future”. In Privacies: Philosophical Evaluations, Stanford, Stanford University Press.
• Scanlon, T. (1975). “Thomson on Privacy”. Philosophy and Public Affairs 4.4: 315-322.
• Tavani, H.T. and Moor, J.H. (2001). “Privacy Protection, Control of Information, and Privacy-Enhancing Technologies”. Computers and Society 31.1: 6-11.
• Thomson, J.J. (1975). “The Right to Privacy”. Philosophy and Public Affairs 4.4: 295-314.
• United Nations (1948). “The Universal Declaration of Human Rights”.
• Warren, S.D. and Brandeis, L.D. (1890). “The Right to Privacy”. Harvard Law Review: 1-19.
• Winner, L. (1977). Autonomous Technology: Technics-out-of-control as a Theme for Political Thought, The MIT Press.

Author Information

Kevin Macnish
Email: Kevin.Macnish@gmail.com
University of Leeds
United Kingdom