Causal Role Theories of Functional Explanation

Functional explanations are a type of explanation offered in the natural and social sciences. In giving these explanations, researchers appeal to the functions that a structure or system has. For instance, a biologist might say, “The kidney has the function of eliminating waste products from the bloodstream.” Or a sociologist might say, “The purpose of monogamy is to preserve the family structure.” Each of these is concerned with a function that a structure or system is believed to possess. Philosophical interest in this issue concerns understanding what exactly these statements amount to, and whether they are explanatory. Of particular concern is whether such statements commit us to problematic views about the existence of teleology, or purposes, in nature, and whether this is legitimate in the sciences.

This article considers the debate over functional explanations in the philosophical literature from the 1950’s to the early 21^st century. It begins by considering the background to philosophical interest in this subject. Then it looks at two prominent early approaches to functional explanation: Ernest Nagel’s deductive-nomological approach from the 1950’s, and Robert Cummins’ causal account from the 1970’s, as well as objections to both. Throughout there is consideration of illustrative examples of functional explanations from different sciences. Although there are other accounts of functional explanation in the literature, such as the evolutionary and design-oriented accounts, they will be mentioned only in relation to the other two. The broad history of the concept of teleology and the details of the other accounts will not be developed here.

Background
Nagel’s Early Account
Difficulties
Cummins’ View
An Example
Objections and Replies
Other Developments
References and Further Reading
1. References
2. Suggested Reading

1. Background

Prior to the 1950’s, philosophers and scientists were concerned with appeals to teleological concepts in the sciences. These concepts have a history going back to Aristotle, who claimed that understanding such things as physical objects or an animal’s physiological structures involves knowing what they are for. In his view, a complete explanation of these structures requires understanding the purposes towards which they are directed. For instance, he thought that one does not understand what a kidney is merely by knowing the material it is made from; one also has to understand that it has the purpose of filtering blood (what it’s for). In Aristotle’s view purposes were conceived as unusual properties like “ends” or “final causes”. But after the scientific revolution these properties were hard to understand in a manner consistent with the sciences, and were considered to be obscure. At a later point this way of thinking was also believed by many to have become questionable because of Darwin’s theory of evolution, which held that talk of Aristotelian purposes was problematic. The idea was to replace talk of such purposes with reference to the notion of natural selection and the environment. The theory of evolution was taken by many scientists to show that appeals to purposive concepts in biology and the social sciences were merely misguided appeals to an outmoded form of explanation. However, the difficulty remained and scientists often continued through the 1900’s to use purposive language in explaining the phenomena that interested them. If appeals to purposive concepts were misguided, then one would have expected these appeals to wither away. So a problem remained in the scientific community over what this situation implied. There was concern about whether this continued talk of purposes was illegitimate in the sciences, or whether there was an acceptable way of understanding such language.

2. Nagel’s Early Account

Modern discussions of functional explanation usually begin with the views developed by Ernest Nagel and others around the 1950’s in the context of scientific explanation (Nagel 1961; Hempel 1959). In his book The Structure of Science, one of Nagel’s concerns was describing the various forms of explanation that occur in the sciences. When we consider the biological and social sciences, he observes, we often find researchers describing the structures or systems that concern them in terms of the functions they have. For instance, a biologist might say, “The heart has the function of pumping blood through the circulatory system.” Or a sociologist might say, “The purpose of the religious ritual is to increase cohesion in society.” Put generally, Nagel says these statements can be understood as stating that “the function of system X is to do Y.” He claims that there are several issues that such statements raise for further examination. We want to understand the detailed structure of such statements and how they work. We also want to understand how these statements are related to other kinds of explanations offered in the natural and social sciences.

Nagel claims that functional statements can be understood in the following manner. These statements are explanation sketches that when fully spelled out reduce to another form of explanation common in the physical sciences called the Deductive-Nomological model. Nagel’s account focuses on the attributions of functions to the components of a structure (or system). Consider the statement, “The heart has the function of pumping blood through the circulatory system.” When understood, this statement serves to explain why hearts are present in vertebrates. To see this, we have to note that hearts occur only together with a certain physical organization of the vertebrate body and in a certain external environment that the organism lives in. So, what the statement really says is that, in vertebrate bodies with an organization of blood and blood vessels and in a certain external environment, circulation occurs only if an organism has a heart. If we focus on this latter statement, Nagel says that the information in it can be expanded into a D-N explanation. When this is done, we then have the following explanation: Every vertebrate body with the appropriate organization and in a certain environment engages in circulation. If the vertebrate body does not have a heart, then it does not engage in circulation. Hence, the vertebrate body must have a heart.

This means functional statements in general have the following form for Nagel: The function of A in a system S with organization C is to enable S in environment E to engage in process P. And this can be expanded into an explicit explanation in this way: Every system S with organization C and in environment E engages in process P. If S with organization C and in environment E does not have A, then S does not engage in P. Hence, S with organization C must have A (1961, 403).

Understood this way, functional statements can be seen as explaining why components like hearts are present in certain organisms in which circulation occurs. For what such statements say is that for organisms having a heart is a necessary condition for pumping blood in the circulatory system. Nagel says this means the statement “The heart has the function of pumping blood through the circulatory system” says the same thing as the statement “Organisms in which circulation occurs pump blood only if they have a heart.” Because of the equivalence, he writes that it appears that “when a function is ascribed to a constituent element in an organism, the content of the teleological [functional] statement is fully conveyed by another statement that is not explicitly teleological and that simply asserts a necessary . . . condition for the occurrence of a certain trait or activity of the organism” (1961, 405).

There are two features of Nagel’s account worth noting at this point. First, he holds that when we attribute a function to a component, this is always relative to a goal state of the larger system. Researchers are not interested in merely any effects of the components a system has. Rather, they are interested in certain effects that are important to the maintenance of the organism. Biologists, for example, are interested in understanding the heart’s pumping blood because this effect contributes to the activity of circulation, which is important for the organism’s survival. It is important to note that for Nagel talk of goals in this context is not intended to make reference to conscious entities of some kind. It only concerns the characteristic activities that researchers believe to be present in the systems that concern them (for example, survival and reproduction).

Second, we saw that functional statements that mention the functions of components can be translated into equivalent statements that lack these notions. Nagel claims this shows there’s nothing scientifically suspect about these statements. We shouldn’t think that such statements commit us to problematic entities like “purposes” in nature that somehow attach to components, or to “ends” or “final causes” towards which components are believed to strive (as in Aristotle’s view of teleology). Instead, what the account makes clear is that, in attributing a function to a component, researchers are merely concerned with explaining why the component is present in the larger system. In light of this, Nagel suggests that functional statements are unproblematic despite their earlier associations in history with unacceptable teleological notions. Understood properly he thinks these statements should be seen as belonging with other legitimate forms of explanation in the sciences (on this point compare Ayala 1970).

3. Difficulties

There are two difficulties commonly noted with the account presented. The first concerns the reference to goals in identifying the effects of the components that are the targets of explanation. As we have seen for Nagel, the function of a component is identified in relation to the effects that contribute towards the important activities of an organism, like survival and reproduction. But this is problematic for some (Cummins 1975) since it suggests there are components that researchers might want to say have functions, but with this account do not. For instance, let us suppose that the wings of a particular species of bird stopped contributing to the capacity for survival and reproduction (maybe this is due to a specific type of airborne predator). In this situation, it seems researchers would not say that the wings did not have any function to perform; they would still want to understand how the wings contributed to the birds’ capacity for flight. The present account would classify these structures as lacking functions when some would say they have functions.

The second problem concerns the sense in which functional statements explain the presence of the components involved. In Nagel’s view, we explain the presence of a component by inferring that it is necessary for the performance of a capacity of a system. In the example considered, the heart is said to be a necessary condition for the occurrence of blood pumping in vertebrates. But it has been held false by some (Wright 1973; Cummins 1975) that having a heart is a necessary condition for pumping blood. For surely there are functionally equivalent structures like artificial hearts that are capable of pumping blood through the circulatory system, or circulation might even be achieved in other ways. If this is the case, however, then functional statements cannot be interpreted as explaining why certain structures must be present in an organism (because they needn’t be). Nagel knew of this concern and said his interest was with actual living systems and what they include (as opposed to logical possibilities). But it is not clear this resolves the worry since we find components like artificial hearts in actual living systems (Buller 1999). Aside from this issue, there are believed to be general problems with the framework of Deductive-Nomological explanation that lies behind Nagel’s account of functional explanation, which have raised concerns with his approach. It is no longer accepted by everyone, for example, that scientific explanations have to be seen as involving deductions from universal, law like statements as required with the Deductive-Nomological model of explanation. The result of this was that people became less inclined to think that an account of functional explanation had to be incorporated into the particular explanatory framework Nagel employed. This was important in making people receptive to the alternative accounts that were being developed.

4. Cummins’ View

After Nagel the most prominent view developed along these lines was by Robert Cummins (1975, 1983). Cummins agrees that the previous account suffers from the problems that were described. The point of functional statements is not to explain why certain components are present in a structure in relation to some goal state the structure has. Instead, Cummins suggests that functional statements are merely used to explain the contributions made by components of a structure to a capacity of a containing system. The performance of a capacity of a system is explained in terms of the capacities of the components it contains, and how they are organized. Consider researchers’ interest in explaining what it is for a system S to have property P. Cummins writes that “the natural strategy for answering such a question is to construct an analysis of S that explains S’s possession of P by appeal to the properties of S’s components and their mode of organization” (1983, 15). For example, let us suppose that researchers are interested in understanding how circulation occurs in vertebrates. To explain this capacity, they search for the structure in the body that contributes to this capacity by moving the blood around. They observe that blood is moved through the arteries by some sort of pumping motion. When they learn that the heart serves as the pumping mechanism in the body, they identify this with its function (they report “the heart has the function of pumping blood”). The capacity for circulation is thus explained in terms of the capacities of the components of the system that enable it to perform the task.

There are different stages that are involved in giving the explanation. Researchers begin with a specification of the larger function of the system they want to explain. The explanation then consists in showing how the function depends on the capacities of the components of the system, and their organization. There are two stages that are involved in this process. The first stage is to analyze the function in question in terms of the capacities involved in bringing about the function, which Cummins calls the analytical strategy. He says “The Analytical Strategy proceeds by analyzing a disposition [function] into a number of other relatively less problematic dispositions such that [the] organized manifestation of these analyzing dispositions amounts to a manifestation of the analyzed disposition” (1977, 272). The second stage is to show that there is a physical structure present that realizes the various capacities. This is needed to show that the function is, in fact, realized by an actual structure or mechanism. As Cummins explains, “Ultimately . . . a complete property theory for a dispositional property must exhibit the details of the target property’s instantiation in the system (or system type) that has it. Analysis of the disposition . . . is only the first step; instantiation is the second” (1983, 31). While the two stages are independent of one another, it is important to note that both stages are needed for the explanation to be complete. This is worth keeping in mind because one sometimes finds discussions in the literature that focus merely on one stage of the explanation and not the other.

Cummins notes that the explanation can be iterated by applying it to the functions of the components cited in the earlier explanation. This process can be repeated until researchers are satisfied with the level reached, or when they reach a level of physical components where no further explanation can be given. In practice, where this line is drawn is relative to the particular interests the researcher has.

Understood this way, functional statements are not used, as Nagel says, in explaining why certain components are present in a system, but to explain how a component contributes to the capacity of the system that contains it. This concern with the causal organization of components is why Cummins’ account is referred to as the “causal role” account of functional explanation. Furthermore, there is no requirement with the account that the larger function being explained be related to the organism’s survival and reproduction (or similar activity). This means the goal state requirement of the previous account has been dropped. In this respect, Cummins’ account can be seen as broadening the number of capacities of systems that are the appropriate subjects of explanation. The broader applicability of the account is seen by many to be a benefit of the view, but we will see later that for some it is thought to raise problems.

5. An Example

With Cummins’ account, the same form of explanation is said to be applicable to a range of different structures or systems in the sciences. The account applies to the functions of structures like the heart in physiology, but it can also be applied to other kinds of systems, including chemical systems, psychological systems, social systems, and others. We can illustrate this with an example from psychology. Consider the explanation of color vision in the human system (Dawson 1998, 163). The function of color vision consists in the capacity (F) to perceive information about the colors of objects in the environment. The trichromatic theory of color vision provides an explanation of how this works. It holds that the function is performed in virtue of the capacities (C_1a, C_2a, . . . C_na) of the components of the visual system (S_1a, S_2a, . . . S_na), and the way they are organized. In particular, the function depends on the capacities of the parts of the eye to produce differential responses to wavelengths of light. Researchers have learned that when light falls on the retina there are three kinds of cone cells there containing photopigments (red, green, and blue) that respond differently to the different wavelengths of light present. These responses are combined together in the retina through cellular connections and produce a distinctive response signal in the nervous system. The signal is sent to the visual cortex in the brain, and leads to the color perceptions we have. In turn, the subcapacities of the individual pigments in the cones (say C_1a) have themselves been explained in terms of the capacities (C_1b, C_2b, . . . C_nb) of the molecular components (S_1b, S_2b, . . . S_nb) of the photopigments and how they respond to light (for example, the capacities of vitamin A and various proteins to change when exposed to light). In this way, the function of color vision has been decomposed into the various capacities of the anatomical components within the eye and nervous system that underlie the function.

In this respect functional explanation is intended to be a general strategy of explanation that can be applied in different sciences. What is needed is for researchers to identify a capacity of the system they want to explain, and then describe how this occurs as a result of the organized behavior of the components which make up the system. In pursuing this strategy, researchers can be seen as undertaking a kind of mechanical analysis in attempting to explain the behaviors of the system that interest them. It is, in part, the broad applicability of the account to different sciences that has made philosophers interested in understanding its details and implications. One will find further illustrations of the account by looking at discussions of functionalism in the philosophy of mind. This will reveal how the account has been used in theories in other areas.

6. Objections and Replies

There are several objections that have been made to the causal role account. Here we will consider four of the common ones. The first is the concern that too many kinds of components can be ascribed functions that on their face don’t seem to have functions. Consider a bit of dirt that has become lodged in a pipe and which operates as a one-way valve (Griffiths 1993). This material can be seen as contributing to the capacity of the pipe to control the flow of liquid, and so can be part of a functional explanation in line with the account. It seems odd to attribute a function to the dirt in this situation, but it becomes a possibility once we have dropped the notion of a goal state from the account. Once this occurs, it seems any effect of a structure that contributes to a capacity can be used in an explanation.

A second objection concerns the various kinds of things that we know objects like hearts are capable of doing. Millikan (1989a) claims that objects like hearts not only move blood through the circulatory system, but also make a thumping noise that doctors can listen to. Making a noise is an effect of the structure that can be explained in terms of the account presented before. But while biologists take the function of the heart to be the circulation of blood, they do not say that making thumping noises is. So the account seems too liberal since it fails to distinguish between genuine functions and mere side effects of the systems.

In reply to these sorts of concerns, Cummins (1975) argues that there is no objective way of making the distinction between genuine functions and other effects. The effects of a component may be relevant to the explanation of different overall capacities. The limits on what capacities should be explained depend on the particular explanatory interests researchers have. Relative to the capacity for blood circulation in the body, the heart can be said to function as a pumping mechanism; but relative to the capacity for making sounds, the heart can be said to function as a noise maker. There is no saying which of these counts as a genuine function in an absolute sense since researchers’ interests are what matter. This response raises issues about the nature of scientific explanations and whether these should be seen as objective, or whether it is sufficient merely to appeal to the interests researchers have. The answer to this depends on what one sees as the appropriate characteristics of a scientific explanation. In addition to making this point, Cummins also added a general restriction on the kinds of explanations that should be given. He said that the appropriateness of a functional explanation is related to the “interestingness” of the explanation being offered. An explanation counts as interesting when the component capacities appealed to in the explanation are less complex and different in kind from the larger capacity being explained. We can illustrate this with the piece of dirt which is lodged in the pipe. For example, the capacity of the dirt to obstruct the flow of liquid is neither less complex nor really different from the overall capacity of the pipe being explained, and so a functional explanation has no interest in this case. This response is intended to place limits on the functional explanations that are appropriate to make in these sorts of cases. But it has been perceived as being somewhat vague in describing the systems to which it applies.

This sort of concern has also been considered by Davies (2001), who argues that there are specific constraints on the effects that are appropriate to use in an explanation. He suggests we can supplement the account offered by recognizing that functions are appropriately attributed, not just to any components, but to those in a hierarchically organized system. A system is hierarchically organized just when the function is performed in virtue of the lower-level organization of the system in question. In this view, the effects of a component are not functional unless they are due to the specific hierarchical organization of the structure. For example, aside from pumping blood the heart beat has the effect of vibrating the sternum in the chest. But this effect does not contribute anything to a larger capacity of the circulatory system, or to other related capacities of the organism. Therefore, there is no reason to accept this as a genuine function of the component in question.

A third problem concerns the character of some of the components to which researchers ascribe functions. Neander (1991; see Millikan 1989b) claims that researchers in sciences like biology commonly refer to components that may be diseased and malformed as having functions. Due to congenital disease, for example, a heart may lack the parts necessary to pump blood around the circulatory system in an organism and thus not work. This presents a problem because here the component will be unable to perform its causal role, and lack the function as a result. Despite this fact, Neander claims that, in this situation, researchers still classify the components functionally as being hearts. She claims this shows we need another notion of function independent of the causal role notion. The evolutionary account she prefers is presently the main rival to the causal role account. It holds that functional explanations are a type of evolutionary explanation. Roughly, to say that a component has a function F is to say that F is an effect of the component that was selected for by natural selection in the past. So the heart has the function of pumping blood because hearts were selected for pumping blood in our ancestors, and this led to the present existence of hearts. With this view the idea is that natural selection confers on components functional roles they are supposed to perform despite their inability to perform their causal role.

Different replies have been offered to this objection. Cummins (1975) accepts that malfunctioning components do not have their causal role functions to perform. If a component is unable to perform its causal role, then this implies the loss of the relevant capacity. A similar sort of view has also been supported by Davies (2001, 176). He maintains that we should not classify components as being malfunctional in these cases. He says that components are wrongly classified this way on the basis of our prior experience of physically similar structures, which leads us to expect the structures will function as the other structures do. But, properly speaking, the structures should be classified as nonfunctional “because natural traits cannot malfunction.” This point is made in relation to a larger complaint he makes that the notion of function appealed to in evolutionary theories does not fit well with the ontologies of the natural sciences.

Another reply has also been offered by Amundson and Lauder (1994). They argue it is false that malfunctioning components can only be classified in terms of the evolutionary functions they perform. They claim that researchers in physiology commonly classify structures in terms of their homologous relationships to other structures, and independently of their functions. Homologies are defined as traits in different species that are similar due to common ancestry (a standard example is the forelimbs of humans and bats that are structurally similar). These traits can be identified in terms of such features as the physical similarity present, correspondence of parts, and other features. These criteria enable researchers to classify structures on the basis of their anatomical features alone. Since researchers can classify a malformed heart as a heart by appeal to its structural features, it is claimed that there is no problem for the account with structures that malfunction. Whether this response is correct depends on how classification works in the practice of researchers in physiology. This has been a subject of early 21st century controversy among philosophers working in this area.

The final problem concerns the role of functional statements in relation to what they explain. As was noted before, on the evolutionary account a functional statement is said to explain the presence of a component of a system. For instance, the statement “the heart functions to pump blood” serves to explain why hearts exist in certain organisms. The idea is that in the past, hearts that pumped blood contributed to the survival of an organism, which explains the present existence of hearts. So, the functional statement points in the direction of an evolutionary account for the rise of the traits which are subject to explanation. In contrast, the causal role account does not provide an explanation in this sense. Functional statements do not serve to explain the presence of the component, but explain the contribution of the component to a capacity of a particular system. This is not a matter of why the component exists in the system, but the task the component performs. The different accounts raise issues about the aims theories of functional explanation are believed to have and what needs explaining. The different perspectives people have taken on this topic are related to how the explanations are used by researchers in different areas of science, and the particular roles the explanations have in these areas.

7. Other Developments

So far, we have seen that the causal role account is applicable to different fields of science. Another issue is discussion over the exact fields it applies to, and how it relates to the other accounts mentioned. In this respect, it will help to describe the relation between the causal role and other accounts as they have been discussed in the biological sciences.

According to Neander (1991), there is a single notion of function used across different areas of biological research. The basic notion is the evolutionary notion we described before that is explained in terms of natural selection. The idea is that the heart functions to pump blood because pumping blood was the effect that hearts were selected for in the past, and which led to the present existence of hearts. Neander claims this is the basic notion at work when researchers appeal to the functions of a component and not the causal notion. In another vein, Kitcher (1993) argues that the concept of design can be seen to underlie all functional explanations. Roughly, to say that a component has a function F is to say that F is what the component was designed to do (the account allows there are different sources of design). He believes the notion applies in evolutionary contexts that involve a past selection process, as well as in physiological investigations that concern the current causal contributions of a component to a system’s capacity (in the latter case, Kitcher claims that a selection process is involved in an indirect way). In both accounts, appeals to functions can be unified under some general concept that applies across different areas of research.

Not everyone agrees, though, that the notion of function can be treated in this way. Godfrey-Smith (1993) argues that it is wrong to think there is a unified concept of function at work in different areas. He suggests there are distinct notions of function that are appropriate to different fields. The causal role notion is appropriate in physiological investigations where researchers are concerned with understanding how the capacities of a system depend on the capacities of its components. These investigations can be undertaken independently from historical considerations about selection. Alternatively, the evolutionary notion is appropriate in areas like evolution and behavioral ecology where researchers are interested in explaining why organisms have the structures and behaviors they have. In this context, the focus is on past selection pressures in the environment, and a historical approach is appropriate. So, in Godfrey-Smith’s view it is a mistake to think that we should be attempting to unify the various uses of functional language under a single account; we should rather accept pluralism. The different notions should merely be seen as reflecting the different kinds of information researchers are concerned with in different areas of investigation. This point can be related to the previous issue concerning the interest-relative character of the explanations researchers offer.

Not only are there concerns about the areas of research where the causal role notion is applicable, but there have been questions raised about similar notions in the vicinity. The causal notion is often thought to be the basic notion at work in physiology (this is controversial for some who hold the evolutionary or other account). Wouters (1995) argues, though, that there is another notion that has been neglected by philosophers in this area. He says that when researchers talk of functional explanations they are often referring to what he calls “viability explanations.” These have a different focus than explaining how a function depends on the capacities of the components of a system. In these cases, researchers are interested in explaining the traits that individuals need to survive and reproduce in their environments. For example, given the distance between the central organs and the outer periphery of the human body, the function of circulating oxygen cannot be performed by simple diffusion. This is why a circulatory system is needed for the performance of the function. This explanation contributes to our understanding by showing why the circulatory system has to be present for maintaining the viability of the organism. Wouters claims that this form of explanation is distinct from the previous accounts we described, and involves its own explanatory structure. Moreover, this explanation is said to share features with the earlier notion of functional explanation described by those like Nagel. In this respect, it is suggested that philosophers may have overlooked an important notion of functional explanation worthy of further examination.

There is a lot more that could be said about the subject of causal role functional explanation, and the debate about functions. We have not covered everything that might be considered on this issue. One thing that is clear from our discussion, though, is that a proper understanding of functional explanations cannot be achieved independently from considering how they are used in the sciences. Whether, and to what extent, the causal role notion is applicable in a particular area needs to be determined by examining the science in question. In this respect, those interested in furthering our understanding of the notion will have to familiarize themselves with the details of the examples being considered. An understanding of how functional explanations are used is an important part of helping us improve our understanding of this concept.

8. References and Further Reading

a. References

Amundson, R., & Lauder, G. (1994). “Function without purpose: the uses of causal role function in evolutionary biology.” Biology and Philosophy 9: 443-469.
Ariew, A., Cummins, R., & Perlman, M. (eds.) (2002). Functions: New Essays in the Philosophy of Psychology and Biology. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Ayala, F. (1970). “Teleological explanations in evolutionary biology.” Philosophy of Science 37: 1-15.
Block, N. (1980). “Introduction: what is functionalism?” In Block, N. (ed.) Readings in Philosophy of Psychology, vol. 1. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
Cummins, R. (1977). “Programs in the explanation of behavior.” Philosophy of Science 44: 269-287.
Cummins, R. (1983). The Nature of Psychological Explanation. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Davies, P. (2001). Norms of Nature: Naturalism and the Nature of Functions. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Dawson, M. (1998). Understanding Cognitive Science. Malden, MA: Blackwell.
Enç, B. & Adams, F. (1992). “Functions and goal directedness.” Philosophy of Science 59: 635-654.
Godfrey-Smith, P. (1993). “Functions: consensus without unity.” Pacific Philosophical Quarterly 74: 196-208.
Griffiths, P. E. (1993). “Functional analysis and proper functions.” British Journal for the Philosophy of Science 44: 409-422.
Hempel, C. G. (1959). “The logic of functional analysis.” In Gross, L. (ed.) Symposium on Sociological Theory. Evanston, IL: Harper and Row Publishers.
Hempel, C. G. & Oppenheim, P. (1948). “Studies in the logic of explanation.” Philosophy of Science 15: 135-175.
Kitcher, P. (1993). “Function and design.” Midwest Studies in Philosophy 18: 379-397.
McLaughlin, P. (2001). What Functions Explain: Functional Explanation and Self-Reproducing Systems. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Millikan, R. G. (1989a). “An ambiguity in the notion of function.” Biology and Philosophy 4: 172-176.
Millikan, R. G. (1989b). “In defense of proper functions.” Philosophy of Science 56: 288- 302.
Nagel, E. (1961). The Structure of Science. Indianapolis, IN: Hackett.
Nagel, E. (1977). “Teleology revisited: goal-directed processes in biology.” Journal of Philosophy 74: 261-301.
Neander, K. (1991). “The teleological notion of ‘function’.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 69 (4): 454-468.
Neander, K. (2002). “Types of traits: the importance of functional homologies.” In Ariew, A., Cummins, R., & Perlman, M. (eds.) (2002).
Polger, T. (2004). Natural Minds. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Wouters, A. (1995). “Viability explanation.” Biology and Philosophy 10: 435-457.
Wright, L. (1973). “Functions.” Philosophical Review 82: 139-168.

b. Suggested Reading

Allen, C., Bekoff, M., & Lauder, G. (eds.) (1998). Nature’s Purposes: Analyses of Function and Design in Biology. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Buller, D. (ed.) (1999). Function, Selection, and Design. Albany, NY: State University of New York Press.
Cummins, R. (1975). “Functional Analysis.” Journal of Philosophy 72: 741-765. Reprinted with minor alterations in Allen, Bekoff, & Lauder (1998) and Buller (1999).
Wouters, A. (2005). “The function debate in philosophy.” Acta Biotheoretica 53: 123-151.

Author Information

Mark B. Couch
Email: mark.couch@shu.edu
Seton Hall University
U. S. A.

The Third Earl of Shaftesbury (1671—1713)

Anthony Ashley Cooper, the Third Earl of Shaftesbury (1671-1713) was an English philosopher who profoundly influenced 18^th century thought in Britain, France, and Germany. As a part of an important social circle of English Freethinkers along with early deists such as John Toland, Matthew Tindal, and Anthony Collins, Shaftesbury’s work had a significant influence on French deists such as Voltaire and Rousseau. He also corresponded with some of the most important thinkers of his day, including Locke, Leibniz, and Bayle. Shaftesbury was most influential in the history of English language philosophy through his concept of the moral sense which heavily influenced Hutcheson, Butler, Hume, and Adam Smith; and Shaftesbury was influential in Germany through his concept of enthusiasm which recovered (intuitive) reason from mere (discursive) reasoning and influenced the Romantic idea of the creative imagination as found in German thinkers such as Lessing, Mendelssohn, Goethe, Herder, and Schiller.

Although Shaftesbury was enormously influential in the 18^th century, his prestige declined in the 20^th century, primarily due to the rise of analytic philosophy which defined philosophy such that Shaftesbury’s work seemed more like literature or rhetoric than proper philosophy. Those trained in analytic philosophy continue to have trouble reading Shaftesbury, largely because he self-consciously rejects systematic philosophy and focuses more on rhetoric and literary persuasion than providing numbered premises. Shaftesbury is interested as much in moral formation as he is in moral theorizing, though his work does contain some, albeit intentionally veiled, discussion of theoretical concerns.

As Shaftesbury saw it, Hobbes had set the agenda of British moral philosophy (a search for the grounding of universal moral principles), and Locke had established its method (empiricism). Shaftesbury’s important contribution was to focus that agenda by showing what a satisfactory response to Hobbes might look like but without giving up too much of Locke’s method. Shaftesbury showed the British moralists that if we think of moral goodness as analogous to beauty, then (even within a broadly empiricist framework) it is still possible for moral goodness to be non-arbitrarily grounded in objective features of the world and for the moral agent to be attracted to virtue for its own sake, not merely out of self-interest.

In his most influential works, Shaftesbury thinks of moral judgment as self-reflection. First we have motives, and then we reflect on those motives resulting in a feeling of moral approval or condemnation. The process is the same when evaluating other agents: we reflect on their motives and feel approval or condemnation. In Shaftesbury’s aesthetic language, the state of having the morally correct motives is the state of being “morally beautiful,” and the state of approving the morally correct motives upon reflection is the state of having “good moral taste.” Shaftesbury argues that the morally correct motives which constitute moral beauty turn out to be those motives which are aimed at the good of one’s society as a whole. This good is understood teleologically. Furthermore Shaftesbury argues that both the ability to know the good of one’s society and the reflective approval of the motivation toward this good are innate capacities which must nevertheless be developed by proper socialization.

Life
Works
Aims and Methods
Major Themes
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Texts
2. Secondary Texts

1. Life

Shaftesbury was part of an important political family. Shaftesbury’s grandfather, the First Earl of Shaftesbury (1621-1683), was an influential and controversial Whig politician. The Whigs were the party in favor of the supremacy of parliament over the monarchy in England. The opposing party, the Tories, supported the monarchy and also tended to support a hierarchical state-sponsored religion, either Anglicanism or Roman Catholicism. The Whigs favored freedom of religion, supporting religious “Dissenters,” at first Puritans, Calvinists, Quakers, etc., and later Deists. In 1679 the First Earl of Shaftesbury introduced a bill into Parliament attempting to exclude King Charles II’s brother James (later King James II) from the throne because James was Roman Catholic. The bill failed, and the First Earl was eventually charged with treason and fled to Holland where he died in exile.

Shaftesbury was very close to his grandfather and revered the memory of the First Earl. Because Shaftesbury’s father had an unidentified degenerative illness, Shaftesbury was raised in the household of the First Earl from the age of four. After the First Earl’s disgrace, Shaftesbury made it one of his life’s goals to rehabilitate his family’s reputation. Though his votes in Parliament occasionally sided with the Tories, Shaftesbury always stayed true to the political principles of his grandfather, consistently fighting for religious tolerance and a balance of powers at both the national and international level (see Voitle, p. 73; cf. p. 414).

John Locke (1632-1704) was a close friend of the First Earl and an advisor to the family for years to come after the First Earl’s death. Locke was the personal physician and general advisor to the First Earl. He supervised the childhood medical care of Shaftesbury’s father, the Second Earl (1652-1699). He also helped find a wife for the Second Earl and he cared for her during her pregnancy with the Third Earl. Most significantly for our purposes, Locke supervised the Third Earl’s education. He personally chose Shaftesbury’s governess Elizabeth Birch and designed a curriculum for her to follow in her instruction of the child. This experience was, presumably, the basis for Locke’s later work Thoughts Concerning Education. Under Birch’s tutelage, Shaftesbury received a strong education in the Classics and became fluent in Greek and Latin by the age of eleven. Locke continued to check on Shaftesbury’s progress over the years. After the First Earl’s death when Shaftesbury was twelve years old, he attended Winchester College, a secondary school which at the time was dominated by Tory sentiment. Shaftesbury felt persecuted by his peers on account of the First Earl’s political reputation.

In 1687, at the age of 16, Shaftesbury began his two-year “Grand Tour” of Europe, a customary part of a British nobleman’s education during the period. After an extended stay in Paris, Shaftesbury spent most of his tour in Italy where, based on his diary, he focused his attention on art and architecture. He was especially interested in ruins from the classical Roman period. The first stop on his tour, however, was Holland where Shaftesbury spent several months visiting John Locke.

After returning from his Grand Tour in 1689, Shaftesbury took over managing much of the family estates and interests from his bedridden father. Shaftesbury also had to supervise the education of his brothers and the marriages of his sisters; oversee the family finances and investments; govern the family lands, a job which included adjudicating disputes among the tenants; and, in 1695, take his place as a member of Parliament in the House of Commons. Locke served as a primary advisor to the young Shaftesbury as he found his footing in these new duties, though Shaftesbury did not always follow Locke’s advice. Shaftesbury had many philosophical conversations with Locke, some of which are preserved in correspondence. During this time, Shaftesbury wrote his first philosophical works, An Inquiry Concerning Virtue or Merit and the “Preface” to his edition of Whichcote’s sermons.

The smoky, polluted air of London did not agree with Shaftesbury, and he developed what would become a life-long and eventually fatal respiratory disease. Shaftesbury was diagnosed with a form of asthma, though Voitle suggests that the evidence points toward tuberculosis (Voitle, p. 226). In 1698, due to his health, he retired from public life and spent a year in Holland where he met important thinkers of the day including Pierre Bayle (1647-1706), who became a close friend, despite their philosophical disagreements.

While in retirement he also began keeping his philosophical journal, which he labeled Askemata (Greek: exercises), posthumously published under the title of Philosophical Regimen. The Askemata reveals Shaftesbury as a disciple of the ancient Stoics, especially Epictetus and Marcus Aurelius.

After the death of his father, Shaftesbury inherited the title of Earl and felt obligated to return to Parliament in 1700 (this time in the House of Lords). Yet his health continued to worsen, and he gradually spent more and more time in retirement, during which time he prepared his philosophical works for publication. By the time his collected works appeared in 1711 as Characteristics of Men, Manners, Opinions, Times, Shaftesbury’s health was so poor he decided to move to Italy in search of a more hospitable climate. There he continued to write. He prepared a revised second edition of the Characteristics, reading the work aloud to see how it sounded and making changes mostly in style and grammar. He also added important illustrations, an allegorical headpiece for each treatise. Finally, he began a sequel to the Characteristics to be titled Second Characters. The warm, sulphurous air off the Bay of Naples did help Shaftesbury’s health, but not enough. He died in 1714 without finishing his work.

2. Works

Shaftesbury’s first publication was a collection of sermons written by Cambridge Platonist Benjamin Whichcote. His introduction to that volume praised Whichcote for maintaining the goodness of human nature and the existence of a natural impulse toward benevolence. This was in contrast to most other 17^th century divines who followed secular thinkers in holding that self-interest is the only motive to action and were therefore required to ground moral motivation in the rewards and punishments of the afterlife.

Shaftesbury’s major work Characteristics of Men, Manners, Opinions, Times (first edition published 1711) is an anthology of five previously published essays, sometimes with substantial revisions: An Inquiry Concerning Virtue or Merit (1699); A Letter Concerning Enthusiasm (1708); Sensus Communis, An Essay on the Freedom of Wit and Humor (1709); The Moralists, A Philosophical Rhapsody (1709); and Soliloquy, or Advice to an Author (1710). Along with these earlier works, Shaftesbury appended five new chapters of Miscellaneous Reflections roughly corresponding to the five essays which attempt to bring some coherence to the collection by commenting on and qualifying Shaftesbury’s earlier views.

His other published philosophical works include A Notion of the Historical Draught or Tablature of the Judgment Hercules and A Letter Concerning Design, originally a set of instructions for a painting Shaftesbury had commissioned and a letter commenting on those instructions, both written in 1712. Shaftesbury planned to include these works in a projected sequel to the Characteristics called Second Characters, but he died before the project could be completed. The Notion was subsequently included in the posthumous 1714 edition of the Characteristics, while the Letter Concerning Design was also added in the 1732 edition. These two late works were included, along with some of Shaftesbury’s unfinished works (including a dialogue called The Picture of Cebes and a treatise to be entitled Plastics, an Epistolary Excursion in the Original Progress and Power of Designatory Art), in Benjamin Rand’s attempted reconstruction of Second Characters, published in 1914.

Finally, we have some of Shaftesbury’s correspondence and private journals (the Askemata), albeit in an unreliable transcription reordered and edited by Rand, published in 1900 under the title The Life, Unpublished Letters, and Philosophical Regimen of Anthony, Earl of Shaftesbury.

3. Aims and Methods

Shaftesbury is primarily known in the history of philosophy for two things. To moral philosophers he is known as the father of moral sense theory in British moralism; and to philosophers of art, he is known as “the first great aesthetician that England produced” (Cassirer 1953, 166) whose work was seminal for the German Romantics. But neither of these is what Shaftesbury himself thought was most important about his work. Shaftesbury was not simply working out an epistemology of ethics or an account of aesthetic experience. He did examine both of these issues, but his more direct interest was in transforming British moral inquiry by synthesizing ethics and aesthetics.

To use Shaftesbury’s own terms, the chief aim of his work is to introduce the concepts of “moral beauty” and “moral taste” to eighteenth century British society. In the final chapter of the Characteristics Shaftesbury sums up his overall project: “It has been the main scope and principal end of these volumes to assert the reality of a beauty and charm in moral as well as natural subjects, and to demonstrate the reasonableness of a proportionate taste and determinate choice in life and manners” (Miscellaneous Reflections V.iii, 466). Earlier he claims he is “intent chiefly on this single point, to discover how we may to best advantage form within ourselves what in the polite world is called a relish or good taste” (Miscellaneous Reflections III.i, 404). Therefore Shaftesbury’s goal is to show that not every preference is equally appropriate to human nature and that there is such a thing as “good taste” in art and morality.

Shaftesbury’s writing style is intrinsically related to his philosophical goals. Since Shaftesbury’s major audience was genteel or “polite” society, he often writes in a playfully oblique and ironic rhetorical style. He uses elaborate analogies and metaphors to entertain and disarm his readers but not necessarily to carry any great philosophical weight (the most significant and easily misunderstood being the famous analogy of moral judgment with sensation). Therefore modern readers must always keep in mind the looseness and lack of analytic rigor with which Shaftesbury approaches his material. He is trying to provide powerful suggestions aimed at forming his readers’ moral sentiments rather than to give detailed arguments to establish a theoretical system. In other words, Shaftesbury wants to help his readers actually develop good moral taste, not merely to theorize about it.

4. Major Themes

a. Moral Realism

Shaftesbury did not see himself as inventing a new synthesis of aesthetics and ethics. Rather, he thought he was protecting a classical synthesis. And Shaftesbury thought the primary threat to the classical notions of moral beauty and moral taste came from the empiricist philosophy of Hobbes and Locke.

The four elements of Hobbes’s view to which Shaftesbury objected were empiricism, mechanism, voluntarism, and egoism. Empiricism rejected innate ideas of morality. Instead, moral principles were understood as a result of subjective emotions whereas classical moral philosophy saw moral principles as deriving from the human being’s objective teleology. The modern mechanistic physics, however, rejected natural teleology. If there was to be a set of universal moral principles, it could not be grounded on universal human nature, but it must be, as voluntarism asserts, grounded on a sovereign will (either God’s or the human government’s) expressed in positive law.

Shaftesbury believed Hobbes had reduced morality to self-interest, and it is to this Hobbesian “skepticism” that Shaftesbury is responding. But Shaftesbury also had another, more personal target. As a child Shaftesbury had been tutored by John Locke, a personal advisor of his grandfather. But as Shaftesbury grew up, he came to reject the moral skepticism he thought followed from Locke’s empiricism and voluntaristic divine command theory. According to Shaftesbury, many of those who rejected Hobbes’s political philosophy, including the “free writers” (read: deists) and Locke, nevertheless went “in the self-same tract” as Hobbes’s philosophy. Shaftesbury goes on to argue that Locke was in fact more dangerous than Hobbes or the Deists because, unlike them, Locke had the reputation of “sincerity as a most zealous ‘Christian’ and believer” and was thus able to make the nominalist position attractive to a wide audience. And it was Locke who had succeeded in convincing many of the British moralists to give up the idea of goodness as natural rather than as socially constructed.

It was Mr. Locke that struck the home blow: for Mr. Hobbes’s character and base slavish principles in government took off the poison of his philosophy. ’Twas Mr. Locke that struck at all fundamentals, threw all order and virtue out of the world, and made the very ideas of these (which are the same as those of God) “unnatural,” and without foundation in our minds. (Rand 1900, p. 403)

Hence it was against Locke that Shaftesbury thought morality most needed to be defended.

What bothered Shaftesbury and many of his contemporaries about Hobbes and Locke were the empiricists’ apparent rejection of the “reality” of virtue. In his dialogue The Moralists, Shaftesbury has the character Philocles distinguish two ways modern religious philosophers defended the link between religion and morality: “Some of them hold zealously for virtue, and are realists in the point. Others, one may say, are only nominal moralists by making virtue nothing in itself, a creature of will only or a mere name of fashion” (The Moralists, II.2, p. 262, my emphasis). Later in the dialogue, the character Theocles says that the author of “a certain fair Inquiry” (i.e., Shaftesbury’s own Inquiry Concerning Virtue and Merit) argued against a specifically religious basis for ethics:

For being, in respect of virtue, what you lately called a realist, he endeavours to show that it is really something in itself and in the nature of things, not arbitrary or factitious (if I may so speak), not constituted from without or dependent on custom, fancy or will, not even on the supreme will itself, which can no way govern it but, being necessarily good, is governed by it and ever uniform with it. (The Moralists, II.3, p. 266-7)

Here a “realist” about virtue is someone who holds the view that morality is “in the nature of things.” On this scheme, then, moral realism is opposed not only to relativism (the view that morality is constituted by “custom”) and subjectivism (the view that morality is constituted by an individual’s “fancy”) but also to voluntarism (the view that morality is constituted by the “will” of a sovereign, whether Locke’s God or Hobbes’s Leviathan). So, according to Shaftesbury, to give morality a subjective basis in individual self-interest (even if one then attempted to construct on this subjective basis a set of objective and universal moral laws), rather than an objective basis in some intrinsic feature of character or action, is to deny the reality of moral distinctions, a position synonymous in the early modern mind with moral skepticism. Conversely, to call morality “real” was to commit oneself to what Shaftesbury’s predecessor Ralph Cudworth called “eternal and immutable” principles of morality.

b. Moral Beauty

Throughout the Characteristics, Shaftesbury argues that moral beauty is a “beauty of the sentiments, the grace of actions, the turn of characters, and the proportions of a human mind” (Sensus Communis IV.ii, p. 62). In general, for Shaftesbury, beauty is a matter of harmonious proportion or “numbers.” The “beauties of the human soul,” then, are “the harmony and numbers of an inward kind” (Sensus Communis IV.ii, p. 63). They are an “inward anatomy” of soul which, like the outward anatomy of the body, must be brought into the “order or symmetry” that is constitutive of beauty and health (Inquiry 2.I.ii, p. 194).

For Shaftesbury, the concept of moral beauty is not merely a metaphorical comparison between ethics and aesthetics. Rather beauty and goodness are “one and the same” (The Moralists III.ii, p. 320) such that moral or mental beauty turns out to be more fundamental than physical beauty. Beauty, Shaftesbury argues, is primarily a property of souls or minds, not of bodies at all: “the beautifying not the beautified, is the really beautiful” (Moralists III.ii, p. 322). When we judge a body to be beautiful we are really judging the act of designing and creating the body to be beautiful. Shaftesbury argues for this conclusion by pointing out that when we say a statue is beautiful, we aren’t admiring the “matter” (the marble or bronze or whatever) but the “art and design” which Shaftesbury calls “the form or forming power.”

Yet terms like “design” and “form” can be either nouns or verbs. That is, we can speak either of the form of an object or the act of forming the object. Shaftesbury concludes, “Here therefore is double beauty. For here is both the form, the effect of mind, and mind itself.” (Moralists III.ii, p. 323) He calls the passive objects “dead forms … which bear a fashion and are formed, whether by man or nature, but have no forming power, no action or intelligence,” and he calls the active subjects variously “living forms,” “forming forms,” or “the forms which form, that is, which have intelligence, action and operation.”

Thus Shaftesbury distinguishes two distinct “degrees or orders of beauty” before going on to argue for a third order of beauty “which forms not only such as we call mere forms but even the forms which form” (Moralists III.ii, p. 323-4). Hence we have these three orders of beauty: first the dead forms, second the forming forms, and third the “supreme and sovereign beauty.” If the first order of beauty is the form of the object in the sense of the object’s design, then the second order of beauty is the active mental subject capable of creating this sort of intelligent design. In other words, the second order of beauty is the human mind itself which, through its intelligent creativity, imposes ordered design on the matter. But, while the mind is a forming power which gives form to the body, at the same time the mind has its own form which is given to it by its participation in the divine Mind, “the principle, source, and fountain of all beauty” (Moralists III.ii, p. 324). Thus the three forms or orders of beauty seem to be natural beauty, moral beauty, and the beauty of God.

Following ancient Stoicism, Shaftesbury thinks of the world as a unified organism infused by the immanent living “soul” or “mind” of God without which even the natural world would be dead and hence could not be beautiful. God (“the universal and sovereign Genius”) is a “uniting principle” which makes individual parts of nature into a system, a living organism directed to a teleological end (Moralists III.i, p. 301). Nature, then, is not simply a “mere body, a mass of modified matter,” but is a rationally structured “whole” which constitutes a “self” or mind whose body is the world (Moralists III.i, p. 302-3).

The teleological element of this view is emphasized when Shaftesbury describes his vision of an ever-widening system of interconnectedness. Shaftesbury starts with the concept of an ordered system: “Whatever things have order, the same have unity of design and concur in one, are parts constituent of one whole or are, in themselves, entire systems” (The Moralists II.iv, p. 274). In other words, the concept of order is teleological: a system has order insofar as its parts are aimed at a single end. Organisms and artifacts are examples of this sort of system: “Such is a tree with all its branches, an animal with all its members, and edifice with all its exterior and interior ornaments” (ibid.). Just as the parts of a human artifact, such as a piece of architecture, are designed so as to form a unified whole, the parts of a plant or animal are also interconnected in such a way as to form a complete system. Thus something forms a system if its parts are not “independent but all apparently united … according to one simple, consistent and uniform design” (ibid.). For example, this sort of “mutual dependency of things” can be seen “in any dissected animal, plant or flower where [even] he who is no anatomist nor versed in natural history sees that the many parts have a relation to the whole, for thus much even a slight view affords” (The Moralists II.iv, p. 275).

But individual organisms are only relatively self-sufficient. Their parts are internally united, but at the same time organisms are externally united to other organisms. As Shaftesbury puts it in the Inquiry:

If therefore, in the structure of this or any other animal, there be anything which points beyond himself and by which he is plainly discovered to have relation to some other being or nature besides his own, then will this animal undoubtedly be esteemed a part of some other system. (Inquiry I.ii.2, p. 168).

So, for example, human organisms, especially as infants, are “helpless, weak, and infirm” and are thus inherently (“purposely, and not by accident”) “rational and sociable” such that humanity “can no otherwise increase or subsist than in that social intercourse and community which is his natural state” (The Moralists II.iv, p. 283). Likewise the human species is dependent on other species of plants and animals for their survival just as, for example, “to the existence of the spider that of the fly is absolutely necessary,” showing that each individual species is “in general, a part only of some other system,” namely “the system of all animals” (Inquiry I.ii.2, p. 168).

Thus human organisms form a system called a community. Likewise, all human communities form the human species (“the system of his kind”), which fits into a certain ecosystem of the planet Earth, which has its ordered place in the universe as a whole. Thus Shaftesbury concludes, “all things in this world are united” (The Moralists II.iv, p. 274).

For Shaftesbury, this cosmic order has moral implications. If man is an ordered system of parts, then “there must be somewhere a last or ultimate end in man” (Regimen, p. 48). Because human beings have instinctive “dispositions of mind such as plainly refer to a species and society, and to the enjoyment of converse, mutual alliance, and friendship, then is the end of man society” (Regimen, p. 48-9; cf. the similar argument at Inquiry II.i, p. 167).

The virtues (things such as “integrity, justice, faith” etc.) are those character traits which allow us to live in society with other humans thereby fulfilling our “end.” Therefore the virtues are “part of a man, as he is a man” (Regimen, p. 50) – they allow us to be fully human and to “live according to nature” (Regimen p. 52).

In this way, the natural order grounds the normativity of individual moral beauty. Following classical Platonic and Stoic sources Shaftesbury holds that everything else is beautiful to the degree that it works in harmony with the supreme beauty of providential design (The Moralists II.iii, p. 277). Thus there is a “nature upon which the world depends, and … every genius else must be subordinate to that one good genius” (Moralists III.i, p. 300).

While the supreme beauty can serve as a standard to ground the particular choices of particular minds, it is not a subjectively chosen standard. It is the objective ordering of the universe. For Shaftesbury beauty in general is a proper ordering between the parts of something according to the universal natural rules of harmony and proportion. Therefore a viewer’s subjective failure to judge the proper objective value of this ordering does not diminish its value. This value is a “symmetry and proportion founded still in nature” (Soliloquy III.iii, p. 157-8). And when “we are reconciled to the goodly order of the universe” by developing beautiful souls “we harmonize with nature and live in friendship with God and man” (Moralists III.iii, p. 334). It is this harmonious relationship to the natural order that Shaftesbury calls moral beauty.

In summary, beauty, whether of a body or a soul, is grounded in an objective standard of order – namely the mind of God as expressed in the natural order. At the highest level this order is the “supreme beauty” of God which guides God’s own creation of the natural order and which we in turn imitate when we bring order to our bodies, souls, or artworks.

c. Moral Sense

In his essay Sensus Communis, Shaftesbury argues for an understanding of “common sense” as a sense of the common good (Sensus Communis III.1-2, 48-53). Shaftesbury finds a predecessor in the Roman tradition which followed Marcus Aurelius’s coining of the term koinonoemosune to describe the same sort of sense of the common good (Sensus Communis III.1, 48n19). This notion of the common good recalls the distinction between one’s “private good” and one’s “real good” which Shaftesbury draws in his essay An Inquiry Concerning Virtue or Merit. The private good or “self-interest” is the “end” or “interest” which is “right” for an individual of one’s species and toward which the natural affections point when they are not “ill.” And the real good or “virtue” is the end in which one’s private good harmonizes with the common good of one’s species as a whole (Inquiry I.II.1, p. 167). Note that pursuing one’s private good is not necessarily selfish. In fact, for Shaftesbury, pursuing one’s private good is necessary, natural, and therefore good (insofar as it does not conflict with the public good). “Selfishness” is not just any regard for one’s private good, but an “immoderate” one which is “inconsistent with the interest of the species or public” (Inquiry I.II.2, p. 170).

Shaftesbury emphasizes the importance of one’s relation to society when he says that a creature is “nowise” good (that is, neither “privately” nor “really” good) if it is naturally part of a “system” but is either detached from the system or harms that system (Inquiry I.II.1, p. 168). Recall, as discussed above, that a human’s most immediate “system” is society. In this way the sensus communis becomes a necessary component in Shaftesbury’s ethics. On Shaftesbury’s view, for any action to be considered good, the agent must be moved to action by an affection for the good of the system: one can only be “supposed good when the good or ill of the system to which he has relation is the immediate object of some passion or affection moving him” (Inquiry I.II.1, p. 169). According to Shaftesbury, then, we could not have an affection toward the common good if we didn’t somehow represent the common good to ourselves. And it is the sensus communis which allows us to do that. Shaftesbury is clear that it is not enough that our actions be in fact aimed at the common good though still inwardly motivated by self-interest: “as soon as he has come to have any affection towards what is morally good and can like or affect such good for its own sake, as good and amiable in itself, then is he in some degree good and virtuous, and not till then” (Inquiry I.iii.3, p. 188). To be virtuous, an action must be aimed at the common good because we recognize that it is the common good and have an affection toward it as such. Thus a truly virtuous and good creature is “one as by the natural temper or bent of his affections is carried primarily and immediately, and not secondarily and accidentally, to good and against ill” (Inquiry I.ii.2, 171). Shaftesbury thinks this affection toward the good of one’s species is natural and common to every member of the species. Thus a virtuous action “ought by right” to have as its “real motive” the natural affection for one’s species.

Being motivated by an affection toward the common good is, however, only a necessary, not a sufficient, condition for being virtuous. While anything can be good under Shaftesbury’s definition, only a human being can be virtuous. This is because virtue requires a “reflected sense” (that is, the ability to reflect on what is good and right) which requires a high degree of reason. Shaftesbury says:

But to proceed from what is esteemed mere goodness and lies within the reach and capacity of all sensible creatures, to that which is called virtue or merit and is allowed to man only: In a creature capable of forming general notions of things, not only the outward beings which offer themselves to the sense are the objects of affection, but the very actions themselves and the affections of pity, kindness, gratitude and their contraries, being brought into the mind by reflection, become objects. So that, by means of this reflected sense, there arises another kind of affection towards those very affections themselves, which have been already felt and have now become the subject of a new liking or dislike. (Inquiry I.ii.3, p. 172)

The view seems to be that the sensus communis shows us what is good for our species and we naturally “approve” of that good and have an “affection” towards it, thereby motivating us to act. Those actions are individually good which are motivated by an affection toward the good of the whole. Then our “reflected sense” gives us a “new affection” towards the motives which result in good actions. On the next page Shaftesbury refers to this “reflected sense” as a “sense of right and wrong” which he defines as “a sentiment or judgment of what is done through just, equal and good affection or the contrary” (Inquiry I.ii.3, p. 173). The notion of the moral sentiments, as Shaftesbury employs it, presupposes the existence of the sensus communis. A properly functioning person is already motivated by the right affections as represented by the sensus communis, and then our moral sentiment (our “sense of right and wrong”) confirms that those are in fact the right motivations by giving us a higher-order “feeling,” “affection,” or “sentiment” of which actions are done by the right affections. In other words, moral sentiment is a second-order affection toward the “right” first-order affections. Note that, while Shaftesbury also talks as if not only first-order affections but also actions, tempers, etc., can be the objects of the moral affection, it must be remembered that for Shaftesbury no action or temper is truly good or virtuous unless it is motivated by affection for the common good. In sum, after the sensus communis determines the moral action and motivates us to pursue it as good, then moral sentiment approves of what the common sense tells us via a feeling of affection and thereby motivates us to pursue it as virtuous.

It is important to notice here that, while Shaftesbury refers to our moral sentiments as our “conscience” and even as our “sense of right and wrong,” he is not trying to establish a “moral sense” as a distinct mental “faculty” for receiving moral ideas. As D.D. Raphael notes, “the casual application of the word ‘sense’ to the moral faculty is hardly more significant in Shaftesbury than it is in Samuel Clarke, who was a severe rationalist” (The Moral Sense, p. 16). We talk of a “sense of purpose,” a “sense of urgency,” a “sense of adventure,” a “sense of humor,” etc. Sometimes we even speak of morally relevant “senses” such as a “sense of decency,” a “sense of shame,” a “sense of duty,” etc. But we don’t mean to suggest that any of these “senses” ought to be thought of as analogous to the physical senses or that they are special mental faculties metaphysically distinct from our ordinary mental faculties. Likewise, Shaftesbury’s use of the phrase “sense of right and wrong” is simply a figure of speech. He thought we used our ordinary faculties of thinking, feeling, and desiring to make moral judgments.

Shaftesbury sometimes seems to suggest that moral judgment is instinctive, yet this is not his considered view. For example, in the dialogue titled The Moralists, A Philosophical Rhapsody, Shaftesbury seems to advance the claim that our sense of beauty is innate: “Nothing surely is more strongly imprinted on our minds or more closely interwoven with our souls than the idea or sense of order and proportion” (The Moralists II.4, p. 273-4). In this context, Shaftesbury is specifically talking about natural beauty, but, as we have seen above, moral beauty is a function of one’s relationship to the natural order. Shaftesbury notes that we can easily tell the difference between a structure created by an architect and a mere “heap of sand and stones” and claims that “this difference is immediately perceived by a plain internal sensation.” The source of this sensation seems to be the common sense. In the Sensus Communis essay, Shaftesbury argues that true beauty in art requires the artist to submit the “particulars” of the artwork “to the general design” and make “all things subservient to that which is principal” (Sensus Communis IV.3, p. 66), adding that “common sense (according to just philosophy) judges of those works which want the justness of a whole and show their author, however curious and exact in particulars, to be in the main a very bungler” (Sensus Communis IV.3, p. 67). Hence it is the common sense (or “sense of beauty” as he calls it in The Moralists) which discerns “order and proportion” so that taste can approve or disapprove of them.

Now, Shaftesbury seems to think this ability of common sense to detect beauty is innate. When we perceive an object or action we immediately (“straight”) distinguish the beautiful from the ugly (The Moralists III.2, p. 326), Similarly, he says in the Inquiry that the mind “cannot be without .. nor can it withhold” judgments of moral taste, and he compares the functioning of the moral faculty to the functioning of a bodily organ: “this affection of a creature towards the good of the species or common nature is as proper and natural to him as it is to any organ, part or member of an animal body, or mere vegetable, to work in its known course and regular way of growth” (Inquiry II.I.1, 192). But these statements are misleading in isolation.

By this point in The Moralists, Shaftesbury has already observed that taste requires cultivation: “How long before a true taste is gained! How many things shocking, how many offensive at first, which afterwards are known and acknowledge the highest beauties! For it is not instantly we acquire the sense by which these beauties are discoverable” (The Moralists III. 2, p. 320). Shaftesbury also says (following the Cambridge Platonists) that the affection for and knowledge of the good can be lost by vice: “contrary habit and custom (a second nature) is able to displace” even the most natural instincts (Inquiry I.III.1, 179). Likewise in the Miscellaneous Reflections, Shaftesbury writes that “a legitimate and just taste can neither be begotten, made, conceived or produced without the antecedent labour and pains of criticism” (Miscellany III.2, p. 408).

If anything about the sensus communis or moral taste is innate, it is the potential to develop good taste. Everyone is born with these faculties. But everyone must be educated in how to use them. Moral taste is a natural faculty but it is also a cultivated faculty. Elsewhere Shafesbury argues that though “good rustics who have been bred remote from the formed societies of men” might have been “so happily formed by nature herself that, with the greatest simplicity or rudeness of education, they have still something of a natural grace and comliness in their action,” it is nevertheless “undeniable, however, that the perfection of grace and comliness of action and behavior can be found only among the people of a liberal education” since such perfection requires knowledge of “those particular rules of art which philosophy alone exhibits” (Soliloquy I.3 p. 85-7). So virtue must be cultivated like good taste in art or wine. Only then can one act “from his nature, in a manner necessarily and without reflection” (Sensus Communis IV.1, p. 60).

In summary, our moral sense is a not a special instinctive faculty, but an innate potential to approve of certain actions that must be activated by good education in society. Once we have been trained in the art of sociable conversation, our moral sense will inevitably approve of those actions which are motivated by the teleological good of society as a whole.

d. Personal Identity

In his essay Soliloquy Shaftesbury describes moral reasoning through the mechanism of conscience as requiring the agent to partition herself into multiple voices (or “selves”) in order to engage in fruitful internal discussion on the model of a Socratic dialogue. Soliloquy, he says, is a kind of “self-dissection” in which an individual “becomes two distinct persons” in order to “be his own subject” of advice and edification (Soliloquy I.i, p. 72). He calls “this method of soliloquy” an “art” or “regimen” which is “practiced” by “all great wits,” especially by “the poet and philosopher” and even “the orator” (Soliloquy I.i, p. 73).

Here soliloquy means something like the examination of conscience. The point of dividing oneself into two dialogue partners is to achieve the kind of consensus that results from rational discussion (Soliloquy I.ii, p. 77). We reflect within ourselves and notice that we are of two minds about something (we “discover a certain duplicity of soul”). Then we discuss the issue with ourselves until we bring the two views into dialectical agreement. In this way we achieve integrity and self-unity within our mind (we “make us agree with ourselves and be of a piece within”). In aesthetic terms, we are trying to bring our soul into harmony with itself.

For Shaftesbury, the purpose of soliloquy is not only self-creation, but also preparation for public discourse. It is significant that the full title of the essay is Soliloquy, or Advice to an Author, an “author” being one who “publishes” (makes public) his “meditations” (private thoughts). Shaftesbury’s advice is that we test our thoughts by the method of soliloquy before we presume to share them: “so that, unless the party has been used to play the critic thoroughly upon himself, he will hardly be found proof against the criticisms of others” (Soliloquy I.i, p. 76). What is significant here is that public edification is the assumed goal of philosophical thinking.

However, prior to public discourse, we must endeavor to construct a coherent self through the method of soliloquy. “Our thoughts,” says Shaftesbury, “have generally such an obscure implicit language that it is the hardest thing in the world to make them speak out distinctly. For this reason, the right method is to give them voice and accent” (Soliloquy I.ii, p. 78). By the method of giving voice to our thoughts here, Shaftesbury has in mind the “meditations, occasional reflections, solitary thoughts or other such exercises as come under the notion of this self-discoursing practice” (Soliloquy I.i, p. 74) that make up his own private notebooks which he labeled Askemata (exercises or “regimen”). In his Regimen Shaftesbury applies the practice of dialectical reasoning to his own inner life via the method of soliloquy.

For Shaftesbury, the result of achieving harmony of soul is the construction of a unified “self.” “It is the known province of philosophy,” Shaftesbury writes, “to teach us ourselves, keep us the self-same person and to regulate our governing fancies, passions and humors as to make us comprehensible to ourselves” (Soliloquy III.i, p. 127). With regard to the question of the self, Shaftesbury ridicules that “which stands for philosophy in some famous schools,” saying it cannot generate “manners or understanding” because “It pretends indeed some relation to manners as being definitive of the natures, essences and properties of spirits” (Soliloquy III.i, p. 128). In other words, scholastic philosophy confuses an accidental property (a “relationship”) of the self with an essential one. It does this by “defining ‘material’ and ‘immaterial substances’ and distinguishing their properties and modes” as if this were “the right manner of proceeding in the discovery of our own natures” (Soliloquy III.i, p. 129-130). This focus on the metaphysics of “modes and substances” is, however, “beside the mark and reaches nothing we can truly call our interest or concern.” It does not tell us who we really are (Soliloquy III.i, p. 130). The scholastics make the same mistake as a person who attempts to understand the nature of a watch by asking “of what metal or what matter each part was composed” rather than “what the real use was of such an instrument or by what movements its end was best attained and its perfection acquired” (Soliloquy III.i, p. 131). Likewise, the philosopher engaged in metaphysical speculation has “considered not the real operation or energy of his subject, nor contemplated the man as real man and as a human agent, but as a watch or common machine” (ibid).

Shaftesbury argues that true self-knowledge comes from the study of the passions. This is because I am my passions: “These passions, according as they have the ascendancy in me and differ in proportion with one another, affect my character and make me different with respect to myself and others” (Soliloquy III.i, p. 132). My character or self is a function of my passions, and that character is the real me, not the material (or immaterial) substance that my passions are made out of (or inhere in). Were my “passions, affections, and opinions” to change radically enough, then I would become a different self, even if, contra Locke, I retained in my “memory the faint marks or tokens of former transactions” (Soliloquy III.i, p. 127). This is because my passions are aimed at what I take to be my happiness (Soliloquy III.i, p 132). And, as the teleological end of my life, my happiness is what makes me who I am.

True philosophy, then, is the kind of self-reflection which makes known to an agent what her passions are aimed at so that she can bring them into harmony with one another and thereby construct a coherent self. Until I can understand my own passions (“ascertain my ideas”) and control them (“keep my opinion, liking and esteem of things the same” from moment to moment), I will remain “the same mystery to myself as ever” (Soliloquy III.i, p. 134), regardless of the truth of my metaphysical arguments.

The problem of an incoherent self arises primarily, in Shaftesbury’s view, when we define our lives in pursuit of pleasure. Pleasure is not stable, since pleasure comes from a variety of sources and the pursuit of pleasure demands a constant search for new sources, for “when we follow pleasure merely, we are disgusted and change from one sort to another, condemning that at one time which at another we earnestly approve, and never judging equally of happiness while we follow passion and mere humor” (Soliloquy III.ii, p. 138). What we need is a “rule of good” which can “control my fancy and fix it, if possible, on something which may hold good” (ibid). This is what Shaftesbury finds in the “honest pleasure” of moral beauty, the honestum which is both attractive and right.

Only the “pleasure of society” is “constant” enough to ground a coherent self, enabling me to “bring my other pleasures to correspond and be friends with it” (Soliloquy III.ii, p. 139). Thus, “when I employ my affection in friendly and social actions, I find I can sincerely enjoy myself” without risking the kind of self-dissolution which comes from pursuit of self-interested pleasures (Soliloquy III.ii, p. 138). Shaftesbury argues the pleasure I receive from moral affection is derived via sympathy (“by communication, a receiving it, as it were, by reflection”) from your enjoyment of my actions (Inquiry II.ii.1, p. 204). In the Inquiry Shaftesbury argues that human beings have natural affections for the good of society, and we cannot flourish as human beings unless we live in society and develop the virtues which allow us to live according to our nature. Thus we are not fully human if we are cut off from a sympathetic relationship with a community. What Shaftesbury adds in Soliloquy is to draw out the implication that we can only construct a self-identity on the basis of sympathetic pleasure. In this way we construct our identities out of our social interactions with others.

Thus Shaftesbury’s account of self-construction is essentially intersubjective and dialectical. It involves at least soliloquy if not actual interpersonal dialogue. Since it is often difficult to know what our true passions and opinions are, we need talk therapy (a “vocal looking-glass”) in the form of dialogue or soliloquy: “Our thoughts have generally such an obscure implicit language that it is the hardest thing in the world to make them speak out distinctly. For this reason, the right method is to give them voice and accent” (Soliloquy I.ii, p. 78).

Shaftesbury’s own dialogue The Moralists seems to be an example of this process since both characters in the dialogue present Shaftesburian viewpoints and help each other come to the truth (see Prince, p. 69). Indeed the assembled text of the Characteristics itself expresses this view through its literary structure. The Moralists is explicitly a dialogue. The treatise Soliloquy, or Advice to an Author, as its title implies, is an internal dialogue in which Shaftesbury is addressing himself. The Miscellaneous Reflections on the Preceding Treatises and Other Critical Subjects, Shaftesbury’s self-commentary, written in the third-person, are in effect an extended soliloquy that can be read as a dialogue between Shaftesbury the literary critic and Shaftesbury the philosopher. In this light we can see that even the (seemingly) ordinary philosophical treatise An Inquiry Concerning Virtue or Merit takes on a dialogical character. Not only does the author of the Inquiry show up as a character in The Moralists (see II.3, p. 265), the Inquiry itself, when read in the overall context of the other more obviously dialogical works of the Characteristics and thus located amidst a series of overheard conversations, begins to read like an overheard scholastic-style philosophy lecture.

None of the individual treatises of the Characteristics is written unambiguously in Shaftesbury’s own voice. The character of “Shaftesbury,” the author of Characteristics of Men, Manners, Opinions, Times, emerges only as the harmonious unity of the other voices. In this way, the structure of Shaftesbury’s work as a whole is an embodiment of intersubjective reasoning. The truth of Shaftesbury’s philosophy is the product of a (metaphorical) community of persons reasoning together through (simulated) interpersonal dialogue. He is trying to achieve what he says Plato achieved in his Socratic dialogues: “they exhibited [real characters and manners] alive and set the countenances and complexions of men plainly in view. And by this means they not only taught us to know others, but, what was principal and of highest virtue in them, they taught us to know ourselves” (Soliloquy I.iii, p. 87).

5. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Texts

Shaftesbury, Anthony Ashley Cooper, Third Earl of. Characteristics of Men, Manners, Opinions, Times, ed. Lawrence E. Klein (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1999) [Cited by treatise title, part, section, and page number.]
Shaftesbury, Anthony Ashley Cooper, Third Earl of. The Life, Unpublished Letters, and Philosophical Regimen of Anthony, Earl of Shaftesbury, ed. Benjamin Rand (Macmillan, 1900)
Shaftesbury, Anthony Ashley Cooper, Third Earl of. Second Characters or the Language of Forms, ed. Benjamin Rand (Cambridge University Press, 1914)

b. Secondary Texts

Secondary Texts
Aldridge, A.O. “Shaftesbury and the Deist Manifesto” Transactions of the American Philosophical Society, new series 41:2 (June, 1951)
Bernstein, John Andrew. Shaftesbury, Rousseau and Kant: An Introduction to the Conflict between Aesthetic and Moral Values in Modern Thought (Rutherford: Fairlegh Dickinson, 1980)
Cassirer, Ernst. The Platonic Renaissance in England, trans. James P. Pettegrove. (Austin: University of Texas Press, 1953)
Darwall, Stephen. The British Moralists and the Internal ‘Ought’ (Cambridge University Press, 1995)
Den Uyl, Douglas J. “Shaftesbury and the Modern Problem of Virtue” Social Philosophy and Policy 15:1 (Winter 1998)
Gill, Michael. The British Moralists on Human Nature and the Birth of Secular Ethics (Cambridge, 2006)
Grean, Stanley. Shaftesbury’s Philosophy of Religion and Ethics (Ohio University Press, 1967)
Klein, Lawrence E. Shaftesbury and the Culture of Politeness: Moral Discourse and Cultural Politics in Early Eighteenth-Century England (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1994)
Lawrence E. Klein, ‘Cooper, Anthony Ashley, third earl of Shaftesbury (1671–1713)’, Oxford Dictionary of National Biography, Oxford University Press, 2004; online edn, Jan 2008, http://www.oxforddnb.com/view/article/6209
Prince, Michael. Philosophical Dialogue in the British Enlightenment (Cambridge, 1996)
Raphael, D.D. The Moral Sense (Oxford University Press, 1947)
Rivers, Isabel. Reason, Grace, and Sentiment: A Study of the Language of Religion and Ethics in England, 1660-1780, Vol. II: Shaftesbury to Hume. (Cambridge University Press, 2000)
Schneewind, J.B. The Invention of Autonomy (Cambridge, 1998)
Voitle, Robert. The Third Earl of Shaftesbury, 1671-1713 (Louisiana State University Press, 1984)
Winkler, Kenneth P. “‘All is Revolution in Us’: Personal Identity in Shaftesbury and Hume” Hume Studies 26:1 (April, 2000)

Author Information

John McAteer
Email: jmcateer@hbu.edu
Houston Baptist University
U. S. A.

Personalism

Personalism is any philosophy that considers personality the supreme value and the key to the measuring of reality. Its American form took root in the late nineteenth century, flowered in the twentieth century, and continues its life in the twenty-first century. Yet, those roots can be traced to Europe and back through Western philosophy to the Mediterranean basin. However, Personalism did not originate exclusively in America, Europe, the Mediterranean basin, or in the West. Personalism thrived in India through the six orthodox schools of Indian philosophy scattered along the Indus River Valley of the Indian subcontinent, and developed parallel to Personalism in the West.

Personalists claim that the person is the key in the search for self-knowledge, for correct insight into reality, and for the place of persons in it. Other than giving centrality to the person, Personalism has no other set of principles or unified doctrine. Although many prominent personalists have been theists, this doctrine is not a requirement. There is also not a common set of methods or definitions, including the definition of person. Respecting that caution, personalists defend the primacy and importance of persons against any attempt to reduce persons either to the Impersonalism of an infrastructure, such as scientific naturalism, or suprastructure, such as metaphysical absolutism. Personalists focus on the concerns of persons living in a personal world. Between the Scylla and Charybdis of either type of Impersonalism, personalists trace the origin of the concept of person and the development of metaphysical personalism from the ancient world to its flowering in Europe and America. Open to the richness of their philosophical tradition, personalists trace their origin and development both on the Indian subcontinent and in the West.

South and East Asian Personalism
1. India
2. China and Japan
Historical Roots of Personalism in the Mediterranean Basin
European Development and Flowering
North American Personalism
Latin American Personalism
Current Trends
References and Further Reading

1. South and East Asian Personalism

a. India

The religious practice and thought spawned by the Vedic (from Veda, “knowledge,” “wisdom”) texts from at least 1500 BCE, form the back drop of Personalism. The term “Hindu” is derived from the river Sindhu (the Indus) where various schools of practice and thought had formed.

Broadly conceived, Personalism in India originates within the main goal of Hindu philosophical inquiry, which is the freedom from misery. Each system of Hindu philosophy seeks to help persons to that end by giving them insight into the nature of ultimate reality and their place in it. These systems advocate self-knowledge, atmavidya, without which the desired freedom is impossible. The nature and destiny of individual persons is the common theme of the six orthodox Hindu philosophical systems: Nyaya, Vaisesika, Sankhya, Yoga, Purva-mimamsa, and Vedanta. The Vaisesika school is frequently lumped together with the Nyaya (“Logic”) school, and Yoga is classically grouped with Sankhya. Each system promises self-knowledge, atmavidya that bonds the systems into a single philosophical tradition.

Seeking freedom from misery through self-knowledge, Hindu personalist schools of thought center on four questions. What is the self? How is it related to the material world? What is the relation of the self to ultimate reality? And, what is the path from pain and misery to liberation?

First, according to each orthodox school, persons are marked by various characteristics, including a permanent and eternal soul (atman) that exists behind the veil of empirical consciousness, and that possesses a physical body (jiva) that exists as part of a changing material world. While it is agreed that the Atman is eternal, unchanging, independent essence, the six orthodox schools differ whether the transcendent I is conscious or unconscious, active or passive. Each school also recognizes that by being connected to the material world persons possess other characteristics, including agency, will, thought, desire, free will, intention, and identity.

Second, personalists focus on the indissoluble reality of the individual soul and on its relation to the empirical consciousness. That soul, the basic reality in humans and all living things, is a transcendent “I,” (atman) and is veiled by a person’s empirical consciousness. It cannot be the object of experience. The empirical consciousness, the experience of objects sensed or being sensed, comes to be interpreted as alien, attributive, essential, adventitious, permanent, or temporary. Schools differ on how to correlate the transcendent “I” and the empirical consciousness. Hindu Personalism views the empirical consciousness as either attributive or alien, monist or dualist.

At one extreme, Sankhya, the oldest school, interprets the dualism of the transcendent “I” and the empirical consciousness as a dualism of spiritual consciousness (purusa) and material nature (prakrti). Purusa is sentient and passive; prakrti is insentient and active. As sentient, purusa experiences products of prakrti and desires emancipation. As passive, purusa can be understood as unaffected and secluded. In Samkhya, the material world is not an illusion; it is real and stands over against the spiritual person. This dualism is motivated by final beatitude. However, achieving it requires, in theistic versions of Sankhya, moral support, compassionate companionship and guidance from a Supreme Being who possesses perfect knowledge and is capable of perfect action. The Yoga thinker Pantanjali (ca. 300 CE) introduced God into atheistic Samkhyan dualism to satisfy the moral demand of the spiritual aspirant. With that addition, the Samkhyan school becomes a theistic Personalism.

At the other extreme, monism is represented as Advaita Vedanta (non-dualistic Vedanta). Sankara (c. 788-820), the leading expounder of Vedanta (literally, “the end of the Veda”) philosophy, states its principle insight that the self is One with Ultimate Reality (Brahman). Thus, the transcendent I includes the empirical many and the Divine One. The triune of Divine One (Brahman), the transcendent I (atman), and the empirical many is a grand unity. Sankara was the most influential Vedanta thinker who espoused the monistic framework as defined in the Upanishads – tat vam asi )”Thou art that” or (“Atman is Brahman”).

Self-knowledge is necessary for the soul to enter beatitude, to be one with Brahman. During a person’s life cycle, the caste system prescribed in the Vedas, eliminated the possibility of social movement, from lower to higher caste. Self-knowledge focused on one’s place in the caste system and its accompanying duties. The soul through its life cycle within a caste system sought virtue, allowing reincarnation in a higher caste. In this way, the virtuous soul achieves release from pain and suffering to Nirvana.

Within the unorthodox systems, such as Ajivikas (fatalists) Charvakas (materialists), Jains (who accept the existence of eternal selves but reject the existence of a supreme God) and Buddhism, Personalism does not develop. Ajivikas adopted materialism on the ground that sense-perception was the only valid means of knowledge. The Ajivika materialists questioned the validity of theological and metaphysical theories that do not come within the ambit of sense-experience. This explains why they rejected the religious version of atmavada, the belief in a metaphysical self.

Buddhism was founded by Siddhārtha Gautama (c. 563 BCE to 483 BCE), rejected the doctrines of atman or purusa and accepted instead a causal account (paticcasumuppada) of the human personalituy. The person, for Siddhartha, is a causally connected bundle of psychophysical aggregates (namarupa). Kasulis says, “According to Buddhism, therefore, I am not a self-existent being who chooses with what or how I wish to relate to external circumstances.” (Kasulis, 62-63) A Buddhist Personalism, the Pudgalavada arose two centuries after the lifetime of Siddhartha. Smet says, “The pudgalavadins thought that behind the aggregates or groups (skandha) of mental and physical conditions observed by introspection, there must a substrate. Had not the Budda, in a well-known passage, spoken of the ‘bearer of the burden’ – an expression seeming to indicate some sort of ego underlying the aggregates? At the same time the pudgala could by no means be identified with the Atman, because it was merely an integrating function demanded by the aggregates and expressed by them.” (De Smet. 38) Its teaching came too close to the heresy of the eternalism of the Atman and soon died out.

b. China and Japan

Regarding China and Japan, in neither country’s faiths are persons understood as an eternal essence. The Chinese, deeply influenced by Confucianism (551-479 BCE), believed that humans elevated themselves to a position through examinations and service. The Japanese, deeply influenced by Buddhism, understood persons in terms of their relationships with other humans, nature, and the totality of things. They held to a hierarchical dyadic view of persons.

Parallel to the origin and formation of Personalism in India, China, and Japan, Personalism in the West began in the Mediterranean basin, and through Christianity it spread north to the Atlantic Rim, northern Europe and the British Isles, and America.

2. Historical Roots of Personalism in the Mediterranean Basin

Personalists trace the origin of the ontological nature of persons and their supreme importance as key to understanding of Reality to the confluence of Greco-Roman philosophy and Christian experience and theology. Both made significant contributions to the formation of the concept of person.

In its early uses, the individual person had no ontological import. Person is first found in Greek and Roman culture. Its roots lie in the Greek word prosopon that refers to the face consisting of that around and near the eyes (pros + accusative of ops). Soon it designated the masks or faces used in the Greek theatre. Its Latin cognate is persona, probably of Etruscan derivation, phersu. Persona referred to a mask functioning as loudspeaker (persono, per, “through” + sona, “resound,” “resound thoroughly”). The mask was worn by actors on stage aiding them by “sounding through” to be heard by an audience. In the Roman theatre persona meant a character and role in tragedy or comedy. In Roman society, the personae of individuals gain their identity, status, and responsibilities from their roles in a hierarchical, honor-shame society. For example, persona came to be used in reference to the king as king, implying a difference between the important social man and the relatively unimportant singular empirical man. By the end of the second century CE persona became a judicial term referring to a Roman citizen as possessor of legal rights, in contrast to a slave who possesses no legal rights, a non-persona

Meanwhile, as Pythagorean, Platonic and Aristotelian philosophical influences continued, individual persons had little philosophical importance. Plato distinguishes between the individual and the universal, and thereby understands the individual through the universal. The individual Socrates participates in the universal, “human being.” To understand the particular “Socrates,” first know the universal, then one can understand and account for the particular. Pythagoras and Plato used the term soma, body, and played on the similarity between soma and sema, body and tomb. Aristotle, against Plato, calls the individual primary substance and the universal conceptual. First substance is that which stands under (hypostasis) a general term referring to whatever stands under something else. But prosopon gained no ontological meaning through that understanding of substance.

Later, persona took on scant ontological meaning among the Stoics and the Neoplatonists. Stoics thought that God forms an ordered universe, a stage on which each human being as rational plays an assigned part. Each prosopon or persona is not only a social role but also the essence of a human being as constituted by God. Possessing no ontological significance in and of themselves, persons are microcosms of the Macrocosm.

In the eastern Mediterranean among the Jews, the Hebrew word, nephesh is sometimes translated as “person.” However, in ancient Hebrew life and culture no word analogous to prosopon or persona appears. Nephesh is more often translated as soul, life, creature, or self. Nephesh can refer to the animating principle of a physical entity or the existential quality or state of life. Usually referring to a human being as a unified entity, no distinction is made between immaterial and material aspects. Nephesh as a whole is created by God; nephesh is not an attribute of a substance. The form/matter and substance attribute distinctions are foreign to ancient Hebrew thinking. However, beginning with Alexander the Great in the 4^th century BCE and continuing through the Roman period, the Eastern Mediterranean was Hellenized. New Testament writers, St. Paul for example, would have known nephesh, prosopon, and persona, likely aware of semantic tensions that later found their way in theological debates within the Christian church.

The different Greek and Hebrew-Christian understandings of person moved into focus in the 4th and 5^th centuries CE as the Christian church attempted to work out a satisfactory understanding of the Trinity and the individual personhood of Jesus the Christ. The details of the controversies that arose are beyond the limits here. However, central to the controversy was the understanding of the individual person. During the time of Origen (185-254 CE) under the influence of Plotinus (204-269 CE), personae lacked ontological content. Is an individual person an attribute of being; or is an individual person being who, having been created by the free and independent God and who bears God’s image, is free and dependent? If the former, the Greek metaphysical word, ousia, expresses the Trinity, as in una substantia (God) and tres personae, where Father, Son, and the Holy Spirit are understood as three independent Gods. If the latter, person is not an attribute of ousia, but upostasis. Earlier both ousia and upostasis meant substance. Eventually, they were used separately, ousia referring to substance and upostasis referring to individual person. This means that persona is no longer a kind of mask worn by an ontological substrate, ousia. The Greek Fathers, particularly the Cappadocians, led by Gregory of Nazianus (c. 329 – 389 or 390) understood that individual persons are ontologically ultimate, the central thesis of Personalism. However, an understanding of the interior life of persons lay beyond their metaphysical interests.

The analysis of the interior life of persons fell to Augustine (354 – 430) who continued the substance view by defining person as “a rational soul using a mortal and earthly body,” (substantia quaedam rationis particeps, regendo corpora accomodata). Nevertheless, a person is one; “a soul in possession of a body does not constitute two persons but one man.” His contribution to Personalism lies elsewhere. His investigation of the inner experience of persons set a new course in philosophy that would not be developed until the modern period. In doing so he developed a key insight of Personalism, an understanding of reality as Person through an understanding of the interior life of persons. He wrote that knowledge of God moves “from the exterior to the interior and from the inferior to the superior.” Further, he argues that in persons, free will is superior to rationality. Yet Augustine continued the metaphysical principle that the higher can affect the lower, but the lower cannot affect the higher.

In the late Roman era or early Middle Ages, the Roman Catholic Church adopted Boethius’ (ca. 480–524 or 525) definition of person, as the Naturæ rationalis individua substantia (an individual substance of a rational nature). In the meantime, the Greek Orthodox Church continued the doctrines of the Cappadocians, particularly Gregory of Nazianus. Though medieval philosophers, such as Thomas Aquinas modified the definition and some such as Scotus and William of Occam were critical, the substance view of person became firmly entrenched in Western philosophy. During the modern period and the nineteenth and twentieth century personalists continued to debate the substance view of persons.

3. European Development and Flowering

As the grand systems of Christendom in the high Middle Ages cracked under the weight of heavy criticisms from Scotus, Occam, Montaigne, and the new science, a new vision arose in the Renaissance, the emerging self. Though the substance view of persons continued, aided by its institutionalization in the Western church, it was soon challenged. Under Pico della Mirandola, Luther, Descartes, and Locke, Augustine’s careful descriptions and insights into the interior life of persons contributed to emerging selves.

Influenced of pyrrhonistic skepticism, Descartes (1596 – 1650) searched for a new foundation for society, culture, and knowledge, one that measures up to the ideal of certainty as in mathematics. He argues that we can know for certain that we exist and that we can doubt every other knowledge claim, including those of the external world. In this way, inspired by new scientific investigations, he raises problems, particularly the mind-body problem. Rather than the view that God created ex nihilo substances with a rational nature, or persons are substances using a body, Descartes contends that God created two substances, res cogitans and res extensa, mind and body. Central to his view of mind is freedom of the will and rationality. In freedom of the will we find a characteristic of God that is exactly the same as we find in ourselves. God’s reason is so far beyond our finite minds that we cannot with confidence claim that God is rationality. Descartes’ discussion of the interior life of persons in the early 17^th century CE continues Augustine’s insights in the late 4^th century CE. However, Descartes’ dualism of two kinds of created substances significantly differs from Boethius’ view that a person is an individual substance with a rational nature. Though modified, the substance of persons persisted.

The dichotomy of thought (res cogitans) and extension (res extensa) raises formidable problems regarding the relation between them, encouraging some philosophers to emphasize one or the other. For example, Hobbes’(1588 – 1679) materialism on the side of extended things, and Berkeley’s (1685-1753 CE) spiritualism on the side of thinking things. Hobbes’ view is a good example of appealing to impersonal principles to account for persons, a view personalists uniformly reject as a form of Impersonalism. Berkeley’s view moves Personalism into modern Idealism (mentalism), in contrast to classical Idealism (Ideaism) such as Plato’s, and against the Impersonalism of materialism. Under the influence of Locke and against any form of materialism, Berkeley took what he believed a common sense approach. Holding to a substance view of person, he claimed that “to be is to be perceived or perceive,” esse est percipi aut percipere. The key lies in the word “exist.” Descartes had said that things exist either as thought or extension. However, thought Berkeley, whenever we use the word “exist” we must assume that the mind is involved perceiving something. And, when we or no other person perceives an object, that object exists due to its being perceived by a cosmic mind, God. The “absolute existence of unthinking things [matter] are words without meaning.” Neither do eternal ideas, Plato’s forms, exist apart from perceiving minds. They are abstractions only.

Descartes’ position helped create a modern version of the One and Many problem, first spawned by the Pre-Socratics. Descartes held that God can be grasped through ideas in the mind. Spinoza (1632 –1677) responded that God as substance is not dependent on any other than itself. If God could be grasped through a dependent substance, such as thought, God would be dependent on something other than God’s self for God’s existence. Here, two fundamental characteristics of Personalism were threatened, the rational relation of finite persons to God, and persons as free. Since knowledge of the Cosmic Person through a finite person challenges God as Substance, the relation of the Cosmic Person to finite person becomes problematic. Furthermore, persons as free can be held only so long as Cosmic Person and finite persons are in some way independent. Spinoza claimed that substance can be known only through itself, implying that persons are modifications of being, that they are not distinct as required for individual freedom.

In reaction to Descartes’ dualism and Spinoza’s monism, Leibniz’s (1646 –1716) doctrine of monads offers a pluralism. Both Descartes and Spinoza assumed that extension implies actual size and shape. Leibniz wondered why we cannot assume that all things are compounds or aggregates of simple substances. These substances are not the extended atoms of Democritus or Epicurus. Each simple substance is a monad that is unextended and has no size or shape. Each is a metaphysical point that Leibniz calls souls to emphasize their nonmaterial nature. And, each possesses its own principle of action within itself and behaves according its own created purpose, yet they work together according to God’s preestablished harmony. A person’s identity centers on a dominant monad, his soul, whose life is an “unfolding,” set from the beginning. Since the basic nature of persons is thought, development through life means moving from murky confused ideas to true ones, the way things really are. In this way, Leibniz was the first philosopher to reject the substance of persons and to adopt an agency view, even if deterministic. Some philosophers, such as Leroy E. Leomker (1770-1830), consider Leibniz the first modern personalist, where persons are agents, not substances with an attribute.

Immanuel Kant (1724-1804) and Hegel (1770-1830) exerted major influences on the formation and development of Personalism in the West. Kant’s distinction between the phenomenal and noumenal world reinforced Berkeley’s view of “material” substance and emphasized that the only path to reality is through the practical reason of persons. With his claim that compliance with moral law is the essence of human dignity and personhood, Kant exerted the single most influence on ethical personalists. That influence was transmitted into American philosophy largely through the work of Hermann Lotze (1817-1881).

Within that background, the modern Personalist vision was first stated in the context of a philosophical issue lying at the core of 18^th and 19^th century German philosophy. The issue was raised in the debate between the followers of Spinoza and those of Leibniz. For Spinozists, Being is one and independent. If Being were more than one, it would not be independent; and, if Being is independent it cannot be many. For Leibnizians, reality is a pluralism of monads. The debate between the two systems sharpened to the debate between monism and pluralism. The problem of the One and the Many resurfaced. How can they be reconciled? What philosophical view can do so? At least two alternatives surfaced at the end of the 18^th century and the beginning of the 19^th.

The first alternative was Hegel’s. According to a recent interpreter, he sought a “‘unification philosophy’ – the need to unify not only life’s various and conflicting powers, but especially the opposing human craving – for individuality and finitude, on the one hand, and for the absolute and the infinite, on the other.” (Hegel, 48) Hegel sought it by brilliantly blending the organic growth of an Aristotle and the Absolutism of a Spinoza into a dynamic monistic system marked by idealism, pantheism, and rationalism.

In reaction to the rationalism of Absolute Idealism and to individual realism, a poet and philosopher and older contemporary of Hegel, Friedrich Heinrich Jacobi (1743-1819) offered the second alternative, Personalism. He thought that Personalism is “‘that form of idealism which gives equal recognition to both the pluralistic and monistic aspects of experience and which finds in the conscious unity, identity, and free activity of personality the key to the nature of reality and the solution of the ultimate problems of philosophy.’” (Bengtsson, 53) The insight of Jacobi continued in Schelling, in the Speculative theists (Immanuel Hermann Fichte, Weisse, Ulrici), to Hermann Lotze, the preeminent philosopher in mid-19th century Germany. It was primarily through Lotze that Personalism arrived in Boston. When Personalism arrives in Boston the distinctive modern characteristics of persons are in place: numerically distinct; individual interiority; freedom of choice among genuine options; autonomy; dignity; and agency. As Personalism makes its way to Boston and the West Coast, Personalism on the European continent and in England responds to German Idealism, specifically to Hegel.

In the debate between monism and pluralism, the traditional problem of the One and the Many resurfaces. But more, metaphysical monism and pluralism lie beneath many modern philosophies that Personalism rejects as impersonal, dehumanizing. Absolute idealism leaves little room for free will and self-determination and cannot be reconciled with the worth of the singular person. Totalitarianisms see persons as means to an end that exist for the interests of the state. Personalists respond insisting on self-determination, responsibility, inherent dignity of all persons. Individualism champions the autonomous self as its own law giver, making all other persons a means to one’s own ends. Personalism contends persons are communal, open to, cooperating with, and respecting the viewpoints of others. Personalism also rejects any reduction of persons to impersonal, deterministic laws, whether those of society, for example Auguste Comte (1798-1857), or of nature, Darwinism evolution. Personalists challenge Comtean philosophical positivism and Naturalism whether that of Darwinism or Samuel Alexander (1859-1938) by appealing to the dignity of individual persons, their free will, and values.

On the European continent, responses to Hegel led to the development of three schools: Paris, Gottingen/Freiburg, and Lublin. In Paris and under the influence of Existentialism, Mounier (1905-1950), Marcel (1889-1973), Paul Ricoeur (1913-2005), and Jacques Maritain (1882-1973) developed distinctive types of Personalism. In Gottingen and Feiburg Phenomenology developed under Husserl (1859-1938) who addressed the question of the relation of objective reality and philosophical reflection. Later he returned to Idealism, precipitating a break with his former students, who, when on their own, made significant contributions to Personalism. These included Max Scheler (1874 – 1928), Dietrich von Hildebrand (1889-1977), Roman Ingarden (1893-1970), and Edith Stein (1891-1942). In Poland, the Catholic University of Lublin is a center of personalist thought whose foremost representative is Karol Wojtyla (1920-2005). Personalism also developed in Prague at Charles University and under the leadership of Jan Patočka (1907 – 1977), one of Husserl’s last students. In Spain José Ortega y Gasset (1883 – 1955) espoused personalist themes. In Italy, Antonio Pavan of University of Padua ably represents Personalism. Personalism also has its adherents in Scandanavia, such as Jan Olof Bengtsson in Sweden. In Scotland the most notable 19^th century personalist was Seth Andrew Pringle-Pattison (1856 – 1931), whose thought influenced William James (1842-1910), George Santayana (1863-1952), and George Herbert Mead (1863-1931). In England, Austin Farrer (1904-1968) argued for a personalist theism. John MacMurray (1891 – 1976) was the most notable Scottish Personalist in the first half of the 20^th century. In Russia we find a version of Personalism in Berdyaev’s (1874-1948) thought.

4. North American Personalism

Before the mid-19^th century few in North America discussed the thought of German philosophers such as Kant, Johann Gottlieb Fichte (1762-1814), Schelling (1775-1854), Hegel, and Lotze. As demands of academic life increased, young American philosophers completed their philosophical preparation with a year or two of study in Germany. When they returned, no longer fully embracing the old Scottish orthodoxy, their thinking was framed by the Spinoza-Leibniz debate, sometimes understood by theologians and many philosophers as the pantheism-individual freedom debate, and by reductions of persons to deterministic laws of society and nature. Deliberating within that framework, they thoroughly discussed the Personalism they learned while studying with Hermann Lotze at Gottingen. Among that group were George Santayana (who wrote his doctoral dissertation at Harvard University on Lotze), William James (1863-1952), Josiah Royce (1855-1916), and Borden Parker Bowne (1847-1910). That conversation grew into what Werkmeister in the mid-20^th century calls the “first complete and comprehensive system of philosophy developed in America which has had lasting influence and which still counts some of our outstanding thinkers among its adherents.” (Werkmeister, 103.)

a. Branches of Personalism

Those historical roots found their way into American philosophy and formed at least four distinctive branches of Personalism. These four branches are idealistic (against threat of naturalism and realism), realistic (against reducing all to mind or person), organismic (against idealism, personalistic realism), and ethical (against collectivism and reduction of personality to mechanism and the body-brain).

Idealistic Personalism – The most distinctive type of Personalism in America, excluding Platonism or Kantianism, this idealism is expressed in three different forms: absolutistic, panpsychistic, and personalistic. Influenced by Jamesian pragmatism, Absolutistic idealists contend that reality is quantitatively and qualitatively one absolute mind, spirit, or person. All other beings, including physical and human ones, are ontologically manifestations of the absolute mind. Josiah Royce, William Ernest Hocking (1873-1966), and Mary Whiton Calkins (1863-1929) represented this view. Panpsychists are deeply influenced by Leibniz, who held that God, the supreme monad, creates all other monads and places them in a preestablished harmony. Rejecting absolute idealism, they hold that reality is composed of psychic entities of varying degrees of consciousness. Both A. N. Whitehead (1861-1947) and Charles Hartshorne (1897-2000) can be called, with qualification, panpsychists. Finally, for personalistic idealists, quantitatively, reality is pluralistic, a society of persons; and qualitatively, reality is monistic; it is person. The Infinite Person or God is the ground of all beings and the creator and sustainer of finite persons. In that sense, personalistic idealists are theistic. Representatives of this branch of Personalism include Borden Parker Bowne, Edgar Sheffield Brightman (1884-1953), Peter A. Bertocci (1910-1989), and Leroy Loemker (1900-1985).

Realistic Personalism – These personalists agree with idealistic personalists that Reality is spiritual, mental, and personal. They disagree about the ontological status of the natural order. Nature is neither intrinsically mental nor personal. It is a natural order created by God. Realistic personalism is most notably expressed by Neo-Scholastics in Europe such as Jacques Maritain (1882-1973), Emmanuel Mounier (1905-1950), and Pope John Paul II (1920-2005), and in America W. Norris Clarke (1915- 2008) and John F. Crosby (1944 -). In America some realistic personalists stand outside the scholastic tradition, notably Georgia Harkness (1891-1974).

Personalistic Organicism – A recent form of Personalism was developed by Frederick Ferre (1933-2013). Rejecting panpsychism and personalistic idealism and influenced by Whitehead’s philosophy of organism, Ferre argues for a personalistic organicism. He claims in Living and Values that persons are “organisms with especially well-developed mental capacities leading to special needs and powers.” (Ferre, Living, 140) By these powers they can “perceive and manipulate the world, can vocalize and socialize, can create language, can imagine and plan by use of symbols freed from the immediate environment, and can guide behavior by ideal norms.” (Ferre, Living, 140)

Ethical Personalism – These personalists stress the crucial role of values in ontology and the moral life. Ethical Personalism is well represented by George Holmes Howison (1834-1916) who focuses on the Ideal or God toward which all uncreated persons move and the standard by which they measure the degree of their individual self-definition. Practically, ethical personalists concentrate on the dignity and value of persons in moral decision making.

b. Major figures

i. Harvard University

Josiah Royce’s thought was motivated by a religious view of life and reality, with an emphasis on the self and community. He sought to realize his philosophical goals through a synthesis of two traditions: the rationalistic system building of philosophers in the West, and the pragmatic emphasis on experience and practice, distinctive of American philosophical activity since the late nineteenth century. Royce also had a long and abiding interest in science and scientific inquiry and was deeply influenced by Charles Sanders Peirce (1839-1914). He wove these strands during his long and productive career.

At the root of Royce’s system is a concept of the self. Early in his career, the Absolute appears as the Self who knows all in one synoptic vision. Rejecting realism, mysticism, and critical rationalism, his central thesis is that to be real is to be a determinate, individual fulfillment of a purpose. Later he focused more on mediation and the idea of system. Toward the end of his career, the self appears as social. He developed a social theory of reality, a community of interpretation. He called this community “the Beloved Community” whose goal was to possess the truth in its totality.

William James, a leading pragmatist, shared with personalists a key insight. James said, “The more perfect and more eternal aspect of the universe is represented in our religions as having personal form. The universe is no longer a mere It to us, but a Thou, if we are religious; and any relation that may be possible from person to person might be possible here.” (William James, 27-28)

Mary Whiton Calkins, a student of Josiah Royce and William James at Harvard, taught psychology, classics, and philosophy at Smith College. Influenced by Royce and James, she adopted a monistic personal idealism and a personalistic psychology. In 1905, Calkins was elected president of the American Psychological Association and in 1918, she was elected president of the American Philosophical Association.

William Ernest Hocking believed the universe is independent of human minds but is discoverable through phenomenology. Sometimes thought of as the American Husserl, he studied for three months with Husserl at Gottingen. Scolded by the Harvard Philosophy Department for wasting his time with an unknown philosopher, he went to Berlin to complete his year abroad. Yet, Husserl’s phenomenology made a deep impression on Hocking. Through careful phenomenological analysis, Hocking unpacked everyday phenomena and found that “nature can no longer be fully understood from the atoms upward but only from consciousness or selfhood outwardly.” (Howie, “Hocking’s ‘Transfigured Naturalism,’” 219) Philosophy must be idealistic. Further, values keep emerging as we learn more about the world and ourselves. The mental life has unity, is deep and mysterious, and finally coheres in a single will. The finite person is an imperfect image of the universe. Influenced by personal idealism and Royce’s absolute idealism, the final unity is a self infinite in depth and mystery. The self or person is also a natural thing that is completely determined. More than a natural thing, the self is free to determine what will be fact in the next moment. Though nature and mind are in opposition to each other, one subject to the laws of nature, the other transcending them, through the ceremonies of religion that opposition is overcome.

ii. Boston University

Borden Parker Bowne claimed to be the first personalist in any thoroughgoing sense, having developed a systematic metaphysics, epistemology, ethics, and psychology. He taught at Boston University from 1876 until his death in 1910. Metaphysically Bowne was a pluralistic idealist like Howison. But his theism distinguishes his Personalism from Howison’s. God, the Divine Person, is both creator and world ground. Finite selves are created, and nature is the energizing of the Cosmic Mind. As world ground, the Divine Mind is the “self-directing intelligent agency” that accounts for the order and continuity of the phenomenal world.

Bowne was not only a systematic philosopher but also a caustic critic of Hegel’s absolutism, Spencer’s evolutionism, and all forms of materialism. These criticisms were expressed in his famous chapter in Personalism, “The Failure of Impersonalism.” In addition, any form of dogmatism or fundamentalism was the target of his searing attacks, especially when held by religious leaders in the Methodist Church.

Bowne’s teaching at Boston University attracted many young talented philosophers, some of whom formed the second generation of personalists in America. The most important among them were Albert Knudson (1873-1953), who continued the personalist tradition in the Divinity School of Boston University; Ralph Tyler Flewelling (1871-1960), who developed the School of Philosophy at the University of Southern California; and Edgar Sheffield Brightman, who led the Philosophy Department at Boston University from 1919 until his death in 1953.

Brightman (1884-1953) was the leading exponent in America of Personalist Idealism during the first half of the 20^th century CE. Educated at Brown, Brightman earned his doctorate in Philosophy at Boston University under the founder of Personalism in America, Borden Parker Bowne.

Though an ordained Methodist minister and an authority on the Old Testament, for most of his scholarly life his central interests lay in the fields of Ethics, Philosophy of Religion, and Metaphysics.

A creative, brilliant, original philosopher, Brightman, in agreement with other Boston University personalists, sought truth to guide creative living in the most empirically coherent interpretation of experience. Rejecting the skepticism of Descartes, beginning the search for truth within experience, and advancing and testing hypotheses, Brightman developed the distinction between the shining present and the illuminating absent. Pointing beyond itself, the shining present is unintelligible without reference to an illuminating absent. Though the shining present does not prejudice the nature of the illuminating absent, Person is the hypothesis that most coherently illumines the shining present.

Brightman contended that everything that exists [or subsists] is in, of, or for a mind on some level. He defined Personalism as the hypothesis that all being is either a personal experience (a complex unity of consciousness) or some phase or aspect of one or more such experience. Nature is an order generated by the mind of Cosmic Person. Finite persons are created and grounded by the uncreated God, and as such possess free will. Reality is a society of persons.

Brightman’s most impressive work is his Moral Laws, in which he works out, along lines heavily indebted to Hegel, a thoroughgoing ethical theory. In ethics Brightman adopted perfectionism that moved from the abstract universal to the concrete universal. In its moral development, personality should be guided by moral laws, a kind of “regulatory system.” Understood dialectically, “the moral life is a special instance of the relation of the universal to the particular,” wherein the personality can achieve both the best possible and rational freedom. (Deats and Robb, 111) In this way, personality under the guidance of reason, seeks to become the best it can be, a fully integrated personality.

Central to his philosophy of religion is his well-known revision of the traditional view of God. If personality is the basic explanatory model, God must be seen as temporal. As temporal, God is not timeless but omnitemporal. Brightman agrees with the traditional view of God as infinite in goodness, but he disagrees that God is infinite in power. To maintain that God’s power is infinite seriously compromises the goodness of God. If evil is to be taken seriously, the will of God must be understood as limited by the nonrational Given within God’s nature. This nonrational condition in God is neither created nor approved by God, but God maintains constant and growing control of it. This controversial view was debated within personalist circles. For example, L. Harold DeWolf (1905-1906) followed Bowne’s traditional theism rather than Brightman’s, and Peter A. Bertocci (1910-1989) found in Brightman’s revisions a cogent and intelligible theism.

Bertocci, following Brightman as the leading personalist at Boston University, enriched the understanding of person through his work in psychology. Bertocci claims in “Why Personalistic Idealism?” that the person “is a self-identifying, being-becoming agent who maturing and learning as he interacts with the environment, develops a more or less systematic, learned unity of expression and adaptation that we may call his personality.” Bertocci is well known for his view that the essence of person is time. He is best known in the field of philosophy of religion for his wider teleological argument that provided increased evidence for God’s existence.

iii. California

Personalism simultaneously developed in Boston and California. One of the first American philosophers to employ the term Personalism was Howison at the University of California. After graduating from Harvard and early in his career, he was one of the St. Louis Hegelians. A thorough discussion of Hegel, however, led Howison to champion the finite individual and reject the absorption of the individual in the Absolute. In this way, Howison opposes Royce’s absolutism.

Howison succinctly stated his position, quoted by Buckman and Stratton in George Holmes Howison, “All existence is either (1) the existence of minds, or (2) the existence of the items and order of their experience; all the existences known as ‘material’ consisting in certain of these experiences, with an order organized by the self-active forms of consciousness that in their unity constitute the substantial being of a mind, in distinction from its phenomenal life.” Devoted to empiricism, Howison rejected creation. “These many minds . . . have no origin at all – no source in time whatever. There is nothing at all, prior to them, out of which their being arises. . . . They simply are, and together constitute the eternal order.” Collectively they move toward their own fulfillment as measured by the eternal standard to God.

Later at the Univesity of Southern California, Ralph Tyler Flewelling, a student of Bowne’s Personalism, taught Boston University Personalism as enriched into Democratic Personalism. He defined person as “A self-conscious unique unity capable of reflection upon its conscious states, of self-direction and transcending time. The self-identifying subject of experience, possessor of intrinsic values and creative powers. A continuum in a time-space world.” (quoted in Gacka, “American Personalism,” 160; also see R. T. Flewelling, The Person; or The Significance of Man,” 332). Emphasizing personal freedom, dignity, human potential, creativity, intrinsic moral worth, and community, Flewelling promoted Personalistic Democracy. He said, “The only abiding basis for democracy is respect for the sanctity of the person.” This includes respect for those “possibilities which reside in varying degree in every person. . . This means that personality is recognized as an intrinsic value, the most precious possession of society and the greatest source of social ‘advance and welfare.’” (Gacka, 161)

c. African Personalism

African personalists focus on total liberation and empowerment of African Americans, releasing them from oppression, and on the dignity and self-worth, especially lacking among young African American males. The conception of persons and God and the primacy of person are two appealing features of Personalism. Among American African personalists, the best known was Martin Luther King (1929-1968). King translated Personalism into social action by applying it to racism, economic exploitation, and militarism. Following closely its major themes, he emphasized the existence of a personal God, the dignity and sacredness of persons, the existence of an objective moral order and corresponding moral laws, freedom, and moral agency. ” (Burrows, Personalism, 77-78) However, the precedent for King’s social Personalism was set by John Wesley Edward Bowen (1855-1923), a student of Bowne’s, whom Burrows cites in Personalism as the “first African American academic personalist.” Rufus Burrow, Jr. (1951-) argues for a militant Personalism that considers the African American experience. Holding firmly to central personalist themes, he argues in Personalism for the sanctity of the body, the dignity of women, “we-centeredness plus I-centeredness,” preference for the poor and oppressed, immediate and radical social change, and respect for non-human life forms.

Earlier, John Wesley Edward Bowen (1855-1933) became the first African American to earn a Ph.D. degree at Boston University. Devoted to the centrality of person, Bowen argued that the importance of higher education for blacks lay in developing persons into men and women who would occupy important positions in society. Bowen also argued that progress must be intentional and accepted as slow, that social problems must be solved individualistically, and for a “concrete, not abstract ‘brotherhood’ of all persons.” (Burrows, Personalism, 80)

Recently, J. Deotis Roberts (1927- ), a student of the British personalist Herbert H. Farmer and a black liberation theologian, emphasized that the conscious person is both “the highest intrinsic value and is personal, emphasis on freedom and self-determination, and focus on persons-in-community.” (Burrows, Personalism, 80). His thought can be organized around four personalist principles: the dignity of the whole person, God as personal, freedom and moral agency, and persons-in-community. Blacks are not subhuman, as they have often been treated; they possess intrinsic worth as whole persons and not as minds and bodies. The God of the Bible is personal and loves each of the creatures. Though God is responsible for all that happens in the world, humans are responsible for all moral wrongdoing. Finally, humans can fulfill, develop themselves only in community, which implies “sharing and caring based upon fellow feeling and deep fellowship. Ujamaa, ‘togetherness,’ ‘familyhood,’ is descriptive of community.” (Roberts, quoted by Burrows, Personalism, 85)

Feminists agree with the Personalism of Roberts and other black liberation theologians, but they emphasize the dignity and worth of black women to a degree unknown before. They do so in the context of the four personalist principles mentioned above.

d. American Indian Personalism

Vine Deloria, Jr. (1933 – 2005), a Standing Rock Sioux, exploring the metaphysics of American Indians finds personalistic themes, including a personal universe, dignity and sacredness of life, the existence of a moral order, and moral responsibility.

Every individual, whether a person, a tree, a bison, an alligator, or the sun are fundamental to the world we live in. Never isolated, what they are is constituted by their relationships. Each individual has a personality distinguished by its power and place. Power is the living energy that inhabits the universe, and place is the relationship an individual has to other individuals. More broadly, place is the relationships of things to each other. In this way, an ear of corn is distinguished from the person who picks it and from the buffalo that provides meat for nourishment and hides for shelter and clothing. Power and place contribute to one’s habitude, “an attitude or awareness of a deep system of experiential relations on which the world is building or living. The key here is recognizing that experience is the undeveloped and untheorized site where the divisions between subjective and objective, material and spiritual, and an entire series of dichotomies disappear.” (Wildcat, “Understanding the Crisis,” in Power and Place, 34). One acquires this through the clan system developed in geographical and ecological environments. For example, the Seminole, living in the wetlands of Florida establish an important relationship the alligator, while the Cherokee, living in the mountains of North Carolina do not. One’s habitude contributes to the richness of one’s personality, to one’s interrelationships with other individuals, and to an understanding of the path one is to walk. Power, place, and habitude suggest that the interrelated universe is alive and personal and must be approached with respect. Living and its quality depend on it.

All relationships have a moral content. Contemplating an action, a person must consider whether the proposed action is appropriate. Harvesting plants involves respecting the plants, their power and place in relationship to other individuals. Considering the impact on others and the consequences of one’s action, one must never intrude into the lives of other. The universe is built upon constructive and cooperative relationships that must be maintained.

Not only must one’s actions correlate with other personalities but also with the larger movements of the universe. They followed the principle that whatever is above must be reflected below. In their villages most tribes constructed their dwellings after some model of the universe. They reproduced the cosmos in miniature and believed that spiritual change would be followed by physical change. In this way, they participated in cosmic rhythms.

Through these relationships humans understand what they are, what they are to be, and what they are to do. Deloria points out that “everything that humans experience has value and instructs in some aspect of life. . . . The real interest of the old Indians was not to discover the abstract structure of physical reality but rather to find the proper road along which for the duration of a person’s life, individuals were supposed to walk. . . . The universe is a moral universe.” (Mankiller, “Foreward,” in Spirit and Reason, vii)

5. Latin American Personalism

Personalism in Latin America developed in the 20^th century against the historical background of scholasticism (16^th– 19^th centuries) and naturalism and positivism (19^th century). The contemporary period (late 20^th into 21^st centuries) continued idealistic and personalistic discussions of axiology and social philosophy, manifested a shyness regarding metaphysics, emphasized existentialist themes, and witnessed the rise of dialectical materialism. The discussion of Personalism chiefly took place in three centers of philosophical activity, Argentina, Mexico, and Puerto Rico.

In Argentina, two philosophers distinguished themselves. Alejandro Korn (1860-1936), in reaction to positivism, introduced German philosophy to his countrymen and was known as “the teacher of knowledge and virtue” and “The Philosopher of Liberty.” Emphasizing the role of intuition as the basis of knowledge and the social idealism, his views were not fully developed. Franscisco Romero (1891-1962), a younger contemporary of Korn, arriving at his philosophy by way of psychology, was a sworn foe of mechanistic and behaviorist view of persons. Persons are whole, a structure not determined by its parts. They are both of the psyche, the lower, subjective, egotistic aspect of the self; and spirit, the objective and altruistic tendencies of the self. He thought that person is the key to reality. Persons have the ability to transcend subjectivity and grasp a superindividual order, and order that transcends him. Romero thought Josiah Royce’s The World and the Individual as the greatest contribution America has made to systematic and speculative philosophy.

Mexico is the second outstanding center of philosophical activity. Chief among its eminent thinkers is José Vasconcelos (1882-1959). Though critical of idealism and leaning decidedly toward Thomistic realism, he is deeply theistic and personalistic. Holding to a theistic monism, the universe is a living whole that finds its unity in God. His chief themes are individuality, freedom, purposeful creativity, cosmic reality in process, personality, and God. Vasconcelos, unlike most philosophers in North America, was a man of action, standing for the president of Mexico, though never elected. Bergson’s call to philosophers to “think like men of action and act like men of thought” was often heeded in Latin America.

The third center is Puerto Rico, whose most distinguished thinker was Eugenio Maria de Hostos (1839-1903). An ethical and social idealist, Hostos stressed the supreme worth personality, the dignity of persons. That is the foundation stone of civilization itself. No mere ivory tower, idealistic thinker, Hostos gave a realistic analysis of the danger inherent in what he called our “machine civilization.”

In addition to those centers of philosophical activity and their signal figures, other philosophers who discussed personalist themes were Antonio Caso in Mexico (1883-1946), Alejandro Deustua (1849-1945) and Victor Andres Belaunde (1883-1966) in Peru, Enrique Molina in Chile, and Carlos Vas Ferreira (1872-1959) in Uruguay. Recently, Ignacio Ellacuria (1930-1989) of San Salvador developed Liberation Philosophy that focused on the social and personal imperative to overcome dependency as the path toward the fullness of one’s humanity. Common themes among them include dynamic stress on action, the philosophy of persons, freedom of persons, and the law.

Regarding direct of influence of North American Personalism on Latin American philosophers, when Latin American philosophers became aware of North American philosophy, it was Personalism, especially that of Edgar Sheffield Brightman that attracted them most among then-living philosophers. Josiah Royce also attracted them, especially The World and the Individual, as we have seen. But, it was Brightman’s Personalism that exerted the greatest influence. The interest was reciprocal. Brightman established the first graduate course in Latin American philosophy in the United States. (Cornelius Kruse, 149)

6. Current Trends

Personalists in North America carry on a vibrant philosophical discussion. They are developing, modifying, and challenging concepts and themes central to 20^th century Personalism. They include Richard C. Bayer at Fordham University, drawing on Catholic social thought and affirming the dignity of persons, focuses on personal development and a modified market economy. Patrick Grant at University of Victoria, British Columbia, outlines a Personalism approach appropriate for a post-modern and post-Marxist cultural phase. Thomas R. Rourke at Clarion University and Rosita A. Chazarreta Rourke at Duquesne University, heavily influenced by Mounier, Dorothy Day and the Catholic Worker movement, defend Personalism as an alternative to liberal capitalist and socialism. Erazim Kohak (1933-), drawing on the early work of Edmund Husserl (1859-1938) and Max Scheler (1874-1928), developed a personalistic view of nature. John Howie (1929-2000) developed an environmental ethics along personalist lines. Randall Auxier (1961-), editor of Library of Living Philosophers, writes on Brightman, Hartshorne, Royce, and Whitehead and is rethinking time, a category central to Brightman’s thought. Doug Anderson writes on Pierce and American philosophy. Currently, the center of studies in Personalism is in the department of philosophy of South Illinois University, where it is taught in the American philosophy program. Rufus Burrow, Jr. writes on African Personalism, particularly Martin Luther King, Jr. Thomas O. Buford founded and edited The Personalist Forum, now The Pluralist, and writes in education, epistemology, American Personalism, and philosophy of culture. Also, he and Charles Conti of University of Sussex Brighton England formed The International Forum on Persons in 1988. It holds biennial meetings alternating between North American and Europe. Alternating with the international meetings, Jim McLachlin holds a week-long summer conference on Personalism at Western Carolina University in the mountains of North Carolina.

7. References and Further Reading

Auxier, Randall E. Hartshorne and Brightman on God, Process, and Persons: TheCorrespondence, 1922-1945. Nashville, TN: Vanderbilt University Press, 2001.
Bengtsson, Jan Olof. The Worldview of Personalism, Origins and Early Development. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2006.
Bertocci, Peter A. Introduction to the Philosophy of Religion. New York, NY: Prentice-Hall, Inc., 1951.
Bertocci, Peter A, and Richard M. Millard. Personality and the Good. New York, NY: David McKay, Co., 1963.
Blau, Joseph L. Men and Movements in American Philosophy. New York, NY: Prentice-Hall, Inc., 1955.
Bertocci, Peter A. “Why Personalistic Idealism?” Idealistic Studies. 10, no. 3 (1980): 181-198.
Boethius, Liber de Persona et Duabus Naturis. Rome: Tuguri, 1571.
Bowne, Borden Parker. Metaphysics. New York, NY: Harper and Brothers, 1882.
Bowne, Borden Parker. A Theory of Thought and Knowledge. New York, NY: Harper and Brothers, 1987.
Bowne, Borden Parker. Principles of Ethics. New York, NY: Harper and Brothers, 1892
Bowne, Borden Parker. Personalism. Boston, MA: Houghton Mifflin Company, 1908.
Bowne, Borden Parker. Kant and Spencer, a Critical Exposition. Boston, MA: Houghton Mifflin, 1912.
Brightman, Edgar Sheffield. An Introduction to Philosophy. New York, NY: Henry Holt and Co., Inc, 1925.
Brightman, Edgar Sheffield. Moral Laws. New York, NY: Abingdon Press, 1933.
Brightman, Edgar Sheffield. A Philosophy of Religion. Englewood Cliffs, NJ: Prentice-Hall, Inc., 1940.
Brightman, Edgar Sheffield. Person and Reality. Edited by Peter A. Bertocci with Janette E. Newhall and Robert S. Brightman. New York, NY: Ronald Press, 1958.
Buford, Thomas O. Trust, Our Second Nature; Crisis, Reconciliation, and the Personal. Lanham, Maryland: Lexington Books, 2008.
Buford, Thomas O. Self-Knowledge, An Essay in Social Personalism. Lanham, Maryland: Lexington Books, 2011.
Buford, Thomas O., and Harold H. Oliver, eds. Personalism Revisited, Its Proponentsand Critics. New York, NY: Rodopi, 2002.
Buford, Thomas O. In Search of a Calling, The College’s Role in Shaping Identity. Macon, GA: Mercer University Press, 1995.
Burrows, Rufus R. Personalism, a Critical Introduction. St. Louis, MO: The Chalice Press, 1999.
Buckham, J. W., and G. M. Stratton, eds. George Holmes Howison, Philosopher andTeacher. Berkeley, CA: University of California Press, 1934.
Calkins, Mary W. The Persistent Problems of Philosophy. New York, NY: The Macmillan Company, 1910.
Conti, Charles. Metaphysical Personalism, An Analysis of Austin Farrer’s Metaphysicsof Theism. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1995.
Deats, Paul, and Carol Robb, eds. The Boston Personalist Tradition in Philosophy, Social Ethics, and Theology. Macon, GA: Mercer University Press, 1986.
Deloria, Barbara, Kristen Foehner, and Sam Scinta, eds. Spirit and Reason, the Vine
Deloria, Jr., Reader. Foreward by Wilma P. Mankiller. Golden, Colorado: Fulcrum Publishing, 1999.
Deloria, Jr., Vine. The Metaphysics of Modern Existence. New York, NY: Harper and Row Publishers 1979.
Deloria, Vine, Jr., and Daniel Wildcat, eds. Power and Place: Indian Education inAmerica. Golden, Colorado: American Indian Graduate Center, 2001.
De Smet, Richard. Brahman and Person, Essays by Richard De Smet. Edited by Ivo Coelho. Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass Publishers, 2010.
DeWolf, L. H. The Religious Revolt Against Reason. New York, NY: Harper, 1949.
Flewelling, Ralph Tyler. Creative Personality. New York, NY: The Macmillan Co., 1926.
Flewelling, Ralph Tyler. The Person, or the Significance of Man. Los Angeles, CA The Ward Ritchie Press, 1952.
Flewelling, Ralph Tyler. “Personalism.” In Dictionary of Philosophy, pp. 229-230. Edited by Dagobert D. Runes. New York, NY: Philosophical Library, 1943.
Ferre, Frederick. Being and Value: Toward a Constructive Postmodern Metaphysics. Albany, NY: The State University of New York Press, 1996.
Ferre, Frederick. Knowing and Value: Toward a Constructive Postmodern Epistemology. Albany, NY: The State University of New York Press, 1998.
Ferre, Frederick. Living and Value. Toward a Constructive Postmodern Ethics. Albany, NY: The State University of New York Press, 2001.
Fixico, Donald. The American Indian Mind in a Linear World. New York: Routledge, 2003.
Franquiz, Jose A. “Personalism in Latin American Philosophy,” Philosophical Forum. XII (1954): 68-81.
Gacka, Bogumil. Bibliography of American Personalism. Oficyna Wydawbucza Czas: Lublin, 1994.
Gallagher, Shaun. Personalism – A Brief Account.
Harkness, Georgia. The Providence of God. New York, NY: Abingdon Press, 1960.
Hartshorne, Charles. The Divine Relativity, A Social Conception of God. New Haven, CT: Yale University Press, 1948.
Hartshorne, Charles. Reality as Social Process; Studies in Metaphysics and Religion. Glencoe, IL: Free Press, 1953.
Garcia, Jorge J.E. and Elizabeth Millan-Zeibert,eds. Latin American Philosophy for the21^st Century: the Human Condition, Values, and the Search for Values. Amherst, New York: Prometheus Books, 2004.
Georg W. F. Hegel. Hegel’s Preface to the Phenomenology of Spirit. Translated with running commentary by Yovel Yirmiyahu. Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press, 2005.
Hocking, William Ernest. The Meaning of God in Human Experience. New Haven, CT: Yale University Press, 1912.
Howie, John. “W. E. Hocking’s ‘Transfigured Naturalism.’” In A William Ernest
Hocking Reader with Commentary, 217-230. Edited by John Lachs and D. Micah
Hester. Nashville, TN: Vanderbilt University Press, 2004.
Howison, George Holmes. (ed.) The Conception of God: A Philosophical DiscussionConcerning the Nature of the Divine Idea as a Demonstrable Reality. New York, NY: Macmillan, 1898.
Howison, George Holmes. (ed.) The Limits of Evolution and Other Essays Illustrating the MetaphysicalTheory of Personal Idealism. New York, NY: Macmillan Co., 1901.
Howison, George Holmes. (ed.) The Origin of Evolution. New York, NY: Macmillan Co., 1905.
James, William. The Will to Believe and Other Essays in Popular Philosophy. New York, NY: Dover, 1956.
Kasulis, Thomas P. Intimacy or Integrity, Philosophy and Cultural Difference. Honolulu, HI: The University of Hawai’i Press, 2002.
Kohak, Erazim The Embers and the Stars. Chicago, IL: University of Chicago Press, 1984.
Knudson, Albert C. The Philosophy of Personalism. New York, NY: Abingdon Press, 1927.
Kruse, Cornelius. “Personalism in Latin America.” In Personalism Revisited, ItsProponents and Critics, 147-156. Edited by Thomas O. Buford, and Harold H. Oliver. New York, NY: Rodopi, 2002.
Lachs, John and D. Micah Hester, eds. A William Ernest Hocking Reader with -Commentary. Nashville, TN: Vanderbilt University Press, 2004.
Loemker, Leroy E. “Some Problems in Personalism.” In Personalism Revisited, ItsProponents and Critics, 171-185. Edited by Thomas O. Buford and Harold H. Oliver. New York, NY: Rodopi, 2002,
Mankiller, Wilma P. “Foreward.” In Spirit and Reason, the Vine Deloria, Jr., Reader, pp. vii-ix. Edited by Barbara Deloria, Kristen Foehner, and Sam Scinta. Golden, Colorado: Fulcrum Publishing, 1999.
Mendieta, Eduarto, ed. Latin American Philosophy: Currents, Issues, and Debates. Bloomington, Indiana: Indiana University Press, 2003.
Muelder, Walter G. Foundations of the Responsible Society. New York, NY: Abingdon Press, 1960.
Monk, Arthur W. “The Spirit of Latin American Philosophy.” Ethics 72, 3 (April, 1962): 197-201.
Norton-Smith, Thomas. The Dance of the Person and Place. Albany: State University of New York Press, 2010.
Pavan, Antonio. Enciclopedia della persona nel xx secolo. Napoli: Edizioni Scientifiche Italiane, 2008.
Plotinus. The Six Enneads. Translated by Stephen MacKenna and B. S. Page. Chicago, IL: Encyclopedia Britannica. 1952.
Royce, Josiah. The Philosophy of Loyalty. New York, NY: The Macmillan Company, 1908.
Royce, Josiah. The Problem of Christianity. Chicago, IL: University of Chicago Press, 1968.
Royce, Josiah. The World and the Individual. New York, NY: Macmillan Company, 1899.
Srinivason, Gummaraju. Personalism, An Evaluation of Hundu and Western Types. Delhi: Research Publication in Social Sciences, 1972.
Steinkraus, Warren E, ed. Representative Essays of Borden Parker Bowne. Utica, NY: Meridian Publishing Company, n.d.
Steinkraus, Warren E. and Robert N. Beck, eds. Studies in Personalism. Selected Writings of Edgar Sheffield Brightman. Utica, New York: Meridian Publishing Company, n.d.
Werkmeister, W.H. A History of Philosophical Ideas in America. New York, NY: Ronald, 1949. (Westport, Connecticut: Greenwood, 1981.)
Wildcat, Daniel. “Understanding the Crisis in American Education.” In Power and Place, Indian Education in America, pp. 29-39. Edited by Vine Deloria, Jr., and Daniel Wildcat. Golden, Colorado: American Indian Graduate Center, 2001
Zizioulas, John D. Being as Communion. Studies in Personhood and the Church. Forward by John Meyendorff. Crestwood, NY: St Valdimir’s Seminary Press, 1985.

Author Information

Thomas O. Buford
Email: tom.buford@furman.edu
Furman University
U. S. A.

Individualism in Classical Chinese Thought

“Individualism” is used here to denote inborn and inalienable prerogatives, powers, or values associated with the self and person as found throughout much of the Chinese philosophical tradition. Unlike individualism in modern European and American contexts, Chinese manifestations of “individualism” do not stress an individual’s separation, total independence, and uniqueness from external authorities of power. Rather, individualism in the Chinese tradition emphasizes one’s power from within the context of one’s connection and unity (or harmony) with external authorities of power. So while both the modern Western and Chinese contexts share a belief that individuals are morally valuable and may attain an outstanding status as such, the Western tradition tends to view the individual in an atomized, disconnected manner, whereas the Chinese tradition focuses on the individual as a vitally integrated element within a larger familial, social, political, and cosmic whole. Chinese thinkers frequently address issues related to individual value, empowerment, authority, control, creativity, and self-determination, yet they package these crucial aspects of individualism in ways that are generally different from the way individualism has been packaged in the West.

Since the term is not indigenous to China, there is a general scholarly dispute about the relevance and appropriateness of applying the term “individualism” to Chinese philosophy. The inability of mainstream scholarship and discourse to locate and come to terms with native forms of individualism in China has had important ramifications for scholarship, politics, and international relations as well. For example, the current debate about universal human rights is founded on beliefs that individuals can lay claim to certain prerogatives simply by virtue of their existence as individuals. Some Asian polities have used the argument that Asian traditions are not individualistic in order to claim that human rights discourse is not only not universal in scope, but that it is also incompatible with traditional Asian values.

Dispute over “Individualism” in Chinese Philosophy
The Concept of Autonomy in Chinese Individualism
The Self as Individual
Individualism in Classical Confucian Thought
Moral Autonomy in the Mohist Writings
Individualism in the Zhuangzi
Individualism in the Thought of Yang Zhu
References and Further Reading

1. Dispute over “Individualism” in Chinese Philosophy

Scholars of early Chinese thought such as Chad Hansen, Henry Rosemont, and Michael Nylan have often considered the term “individualism” to be irrelevant or inappropriate for studying Chinese culture and history. Popular perceptions also tend to view Chinese culture as characterized by obligation and duty rather than by individual freedoms. This characterization of Chinese culture as group-oriented rather than individual-oriented helps promote the notion that individualism, especially as it is perceived – as a doctrine that protects individual autonomy against obligations stemming from external, familial or social institutions – is inappropriate for the Chinese context.

Other scholars such as Yu Ying-shih, Donald Munro, Erica Brindley, and Irene Bloom accept the concept of individualism as relevant for the Chinese tradition, at least as a point of discussion. Brindley goes the farthest to contend that by denying individualism in Chinese thought, one effectively ignores the multiple ways in which goals and values for the individual are in fact underscored in the tradition. While Brindley, Yu, and perhaps Bloom readily concede that the term “individualism” stems historically from European and American contexts, they generally agree that this need not limit the term’s usefulness as a tool for understanding concepts relating to the value and powers of the individual in China. For, even in the West, there is no single definition of the term “individual” that has escaped scholarly and public challenge and contestation. Nor does “individualism” always strictly connote one’s uniqueness, separation, and distinction, even in Western usages. Furthermore, the lack of a term or even explicit debate over doctrines of the individual, free will, or autonomy does not mean that Chinese thinkers or even ordinary Chinese people did not imply such things in their writings, or experience them in their lives. Making use of such arguments, scholars of this persuasion therefore assert that one can apply “individualism” to Chinese philosophy to gain rich comparative insights and shed light upon the importance of the integrated individual in Chinese philosophy.

The following analysis of texts and their embedded assumptions and claims serves to draw out possible Chinese forms of individualism that appear to differ considerably from Western forms of possessive individualism, which arose specifically in seventeenth-century English contexts. The latter forms focus on an individual’s possessive claims to uniqueness, and autonomy from surroundings. Chinese forms of individualism, on the contrary, tend to stress an individual’s achievement or fulfillment of some potential from within and in terms of a larger familial, social, and cosmic whole. This concept of individualism does not support a strong sense of autonomy and independence as defined through separation or freedom from others, but rather it reveals the autonomy and independence of the individual as a fully attained and integrated being within a larger web of relationships and authorities.

2. The Concept of Autonomy in Chinese Individualism

The notion of autonomy arguably serves as a distinguishing aspect of any form of individualism. The autonomous agent in many Western discursive models is free from certain external influences. This can be seen in the fact that various individualisms of today generally recast the individual as someone with the potential to be separate and different from his environment and conventional norms. They empower individuals by emphasizing their ability to make decisions and judgments independent of mundane influences and norms in the world.

Early Chinese forms of individualism, on the contrary, do not generally focus on the radical autonomy of the individual; but rather on the holistic integration of the individual with forces and authorities in his or her surroundings (family, society, and cosmos). For early Chinese thinkers, there is no such thing as unfettered autonomy or freedom of will. Rather, early Chinese thinkers posit the existence of a relative and relational sort of autonomy; or, a type of autonomy that grants individuals the freedom to make decisions for themselves, and to shape the course of their own lives to the fullest degree that they can—all from within an intricate system of interrelationships. This type of autonomy grants authority to the individual to fulfill his or her potentials as an integrated individual. The goal of such an individual is to achieve authoritativeness as a person while at the same time duly negotiating influences, commands, and responsibilities that stem from his or her larger environment. Therefore, a crucial back-and-forth tug between the self and the various authorities surrounding it is woven into the very fabric of what it means to be a fully attained, authoritative, empowered, and integrated individual.

3. The Self as Individual

Free from the radical dichotomy between truth/essence and appearance that is characterized by Descartes, the early Chinese “self” is not encumbered by a gross split between mind and body, or between true nature and experience. Rather, the early Chinese “self” is more akin to an organism, which both consists in and emerges out of complex processes occurring inside and outside of it as it interacts with and relates to his or her environment. In such a way, the concepts of self and person are much more integrated than in certain, extreme dualistic Western traditions, as stand in constant and ever-changing relationship to what occurs both within and without.

To the extent that the self is conceived as physical, embodied, and dynamic, the early Chinese “self” necessarily entails a different definition of “individual.” While there is no clear term in Classical Chinese that might translate consistently into “individual,” this latter term facilitates discussion of those aspects of the self that emphasize its particularity within a whole. We use the term “individual” here to refer to early Chinese notions of self that concern not so much the subjective, psychological sense of “self,” but the qualities of a person that mark him or her as a single, particular entity capable of exerting agency from within a web of relationships. In other words, we refer to the individual not as an atomistic, isolated, and undifferentiated part of a whole, but as a distinct organism that must serve particular functions and fulfill a unique set of relationships in the worlds of which he or she is a part. The individual is thus a unique participant in a larger whole—integral to both, the processes that define the whole, as well as to the change and transformation that stems from itself.

4. Individualism in Classical Confucian Thought

One of the abiding concepts in Chinese philosophy, irrespective of the school of thought, is that of self-cultivation. The Ru, or Confucian lineage, places a premium on the moral cultivation of the individual using a variety of tools and resources, both internal and external. In the Analects of Confucius, the junzi (gentleman, or nobleman) constitutes the most important ideal for the individual, and any person who strives for such an ideal is to do so by a complicated moral regimen of intense involvement with the rites of the Zhou (dynastic house) and its music; moral education through a morally achieved ruler, master or moral exemplar; and training—involving texts and histories as well as personal resources such as will-power, moral desire, inward reflection and thought, and the active appraisal of how one’s own thoughts and actions compare to those of others.

While one may not wish to call anything mentioned in the Analects “individualism,” it is clear that the individual holds the most valuable key insofar as he or she serves as the locus for self-cultivation and, hence, for the transformation of himself or herself to contribute to a moral society and cosmos. The individual forms the basis upon which authoritative, moral meaning and behavior is to be constructed. Insofar as the individual is considered to be the fundamental site of moral transformation, it is an absolutely crucial element of Confucian thought. So, while the philosophy represented by the Analects does not promote individualism as a moral stance that stresses individual autonomy and freedom from social constraints, it does establish the individual as inherently valuable in the process of moral cultivation, with the potential to be authoritative and fully integrated as a junzi figure within a web of intricate social, political, and cosmic forces. Thus, a type of integrated individualism seems to exist even in the most basic of early Chinese Confucian texts.

The figure whose writings provide us with one of the earliest, and perhaps clearest, representations of early Chinese individualism is Mencius. In the literature prior to Mencius, the individual represents a foundational site for moral cultivation, but the source of one’s moral motivation and insight may stem largely from external authorities. Mencius changes this by appealing to the innate moral agencies of the individual through the concept of xing, (human nature). By naturalizing moral motivation through the concept of xing, Mencius reveals what appears to be a new orientation towards human agency: one that sees the individual body as a universal source of cosmic authority and natural patterns.

Mencius defines sources of moral agency and authority by outlining an internal-external dichotomy and emphasizing the internal resources of the individual in moral cultivation. This is best demonstrated in Mencius 2A2 and the entire Chapter Six, Part A of the text, where Mencius debates with an opponent, Gaozi, over the idea that xing is a source of moral agency and insight. Unlike Mencius, Gaozi advocates the total subordination of the human heart-mind, the seat of a person’s controlling mechanism, the will (zhi), to yan, or what might be translated in the passage as “sayings,” or “teachings.” In such a way, Gaozi declares the absolute necessity of study and discipline through tradition, culture, and other external inputs. Mencius counters this by showing the necessity of stilling one’s heart-mind so that it will allow for its natural, innate moral tendencies to guide the body in correct thinking and behavior.

In another famous debate, Gaozi compares moral refinement to cups and saucers, which have been constructed by man through hard work and external imprinting. His view of moral cultivation strongly denies that an individual’s internal xing could have any moral quality or potential. Mencius responds with an analogy of equal force, describing human xing in terms of water. Just as the flow of water naturally tends downward, he claims, so does human xing naturally move toward goodness. Denouncing Gaozi’s views on the external origins of morality, Mencius insists that only when internal resources such as xing are obstructed, violated, and destroyed through external forces, does immoral behavior arise.

Mencius’ claims integrate the moral motivation of xing with life processes associated with the human body. Taking advantage of a linguistic connection between the terms for “life” and “human nature” in classical Chinese, Mencius argues that the moral agency of xing is intrinsic to basic life processes. To him, moral motivation, rooted in human nature, is inextricably tied to the agency that fills our very lives with health and vitality.

In sum, to Mencius, each individual person is his or her own moral agent by virtue of living properly and healthfully as a human being. By locating the seeds of morality in xing, one’s Heaven-endowed agency for human life, Mencius demonstrates that cultivating oneself morally is tantamount to attaining the proper measures for the basic vital functions of human beings. Mencius therefore not only naturalizes moral agency by making it a universally inherent trait in every individual, he also proposes a radical, physiological claim for a type of individualism that connects proper moral cultivation to the natural growth of one’s inherent xing and life forces.

Mencius is important in the history of Chinese individualism because he grounds ultimate moral authority in the inner, innate resources of the individual. What characterizes Mencius’ form of individualism as a stronger form of individualism than that outlined in the Analects is its emphasis on the human body not merely as a medium of authority or primary locus for the attainment of idealized authority (as exemplified through self-cultivation), but as an individualized source of it as well.

It is noteworthy that all Confucians who postdate Mencius seem to understand xing in terms of powerful, innate tendencies of individuals, but some, like Xunzi, fought vigorously to deny that such tendencies were morally positive. While Xunzi may not be called an individualist in the sense that Mencius may, his thought nonetheless supports a strong notion of individual moral autonomy as represented in the Analects.

5. Moral Autonomy in the Mohist Writings

The early Mohists were famous for their views in social conformity and obedience to political authorities, such as rulers and the Son of Heaven, who abided by the authority of Heaven. There is little that is individualistic about such conformist ideals in a Western sense. However, when one considers that the basis of their views on moral meritocracy and Heaven’s Will are grounded on a fundamental belief in an individual’s rational capacity to know and learn about morality, then the Mohist individual starts to appear much more individualistic than he would at first glance. Indeed, in early Mohist writings, individuals are required to know and choose the morally correct path – that which conforms with Heaven’s Will – on their own. They are thus morally autonomous in two senses: (1) They have the ability to use their rational minds to decipher, come to know, or (in the case of unexceptional commoners and people) at least be tacitly familiar with Heaven’s Will, and (2) They have the ability to choose to conform with what is right.

The early Mohists, who argue explicitly against contemporary beliefs in ming (fate, destiny, derived from Heaven), grant the individual a high degree of control over outcomes in this world. So while the early Mohists do not place extra value or emphasis on the individual or its powers and prerogatives, much less on its self-cultivation, they implicitly grant the individual much agency and control over the course of its life and the type of moral path it wishes to follow. Through their writings one gains insights into the ways in which concepts like conformity may actually go hand-in-hand with beliefs in autonomy and free will.

6. Individualism in the Zhuangzi

The Inner Chapters of the Zhuangzi, generally considered by scholars to have been written by Zhuangzi (or Zhuang Zhou), promote a vision of the individual’s unity with the Dao of Heaven. Whether such a vision is individualistic or not is open to debate. On the one hand Zhuangzi does not explicitly attribute the processes of the Dao to powers inherent in an individual’s body or spirit. Therefore, his writings do not technically fall under the definition of “individualism,” used above when discussing Mencius, which locates the primary source of idealized agency within the mundane individual. In fact, Zhuangzi openly advocates the notion of losing one’s self-identity and sense of self or body in order to fully embrace the agency of Dao. This appears to go against any kind of individualism that might place value on the self.

On the other hand, however, Zhuangzi hopes that every individual might achieve a transcendent self, along with a freedom associated with the transcendent individual. Such freedom – spiritual in nature – is not freedom from a higher source of power, but freedom through it. Insofar as Zhuangzi promotes an ideal of spiritual freedom through individual self-cultivation, his thought is characteristic of the holistic individualism described previously. Individuals are not valued in and of themselves but through their connection with a higher authority or power. Realized individuals – the goal in Zhuangzian thought – are not unique, autonomous individuals who stand apart from external powers, but unique manifestations of the workings of a shared Dao.

The so-called “Primitivist,” whose writings in the Outer Chapters of the Zhuangzi seem to represent a coherent voice in that text, presents a form of individualism more akin to that described in the Mencius above. Whereas the Inner Chapters expound on a philosophy whose goals appear compatible with individualistic goals, this strand of the Outer Chapters goes further to locate value inside the individual from the beginning, even in an individual’s mundane state.

The primitivist writings uniquely emphasize the idealized powers of xing in every individual, which ultimately link a person with the Dao. Using a strong language of internal-external, the Primitivist denounces morality as an external overlay and unnecessary pollution of internal xing. By recommending that each individual place all of his or her faith in the natural, innate powers of xing, the Primitivist suggests that one can rid oneself of impulses responsible for the creation of cultural and social norms. This results in the reversion of the individual not just back to his or her most basic nature – one that is not coincidentally in accordance with the Dao of the natural world – but a reversion of society to an era of primitive political structures and human interactions as well.

By rejecting the necessity of social structures, institutions, knowledge, technologies, and cultural practices in favor of a cosmic or natural law and power that is accessible through the individual, human body, the proponents of the primitivist ideology share a basic individualistic point of view. Such a view assumes that ultimate value lies in what humans possess innately and in what is naturally accessible to every individual. For the Primitivist, this internal, innate, and universal human agency to interact ideally in the world derives from xing, which is ultimately a part of the natural cycles of the cosmic Dao.

The Primitivist illuminates polarities between what is external and alien or internal and inalienable to a given object. In such a manner he pits knowledge and culture in society against an individual’s personal vitality and innate powers. This naturalizes what is ideal by locating it in the cosmic capacity and authority of an individual’s xing. In the Laozi, a text upon which the Primitivist writing heavily relies, the ruler serves as the main conduit that enables everyone’s individual access to the Dao. Unlike the Laozi, the Primitivist presents a utopian vision that speaks to every individual’s direct, bodily relationship to cosmic power. This difference points to a noteworthy distinction between theocratic conceptualizations of cosmic authority and power as expressed in the Laozi; and biocratic, individualized ones as expressed in the Primitivist ideal.

7. Individualism in the Thought of Yang Zhu

One cannot speak of individualistic movements in early China without at least coming to terms with what we know about Yang Zhu, or Yangzi (c. 4^th century B.C.E.), and his legacy. Mencius claimed that Yang Zhu promoted a doctrine of egoism, which the former deemed tantamount to anarchism. Though there is no solid evidence that anything Yangzi may have authored has been transmitted through the ages, we can still gain insight into his views from descriptions and condemnations of his teachings by Mencius and other writers of the slightly later Han period. It is possible that what we have described as primitivist above is nothing more than a strain of thought influenced by Yangist tenets and beliefs.

Yang Zhu, like Mencius, appears to have viewed the self and human body as an important resource for universal, objective forms of authority through xing. We see this through the following quote from Mencius, which states: “Even if he were to benefit the world by pulling out a single hair, he would not do it.” It appears that Yangzi’s so-called egoism is founded on a principle of preserving some aspect of one’s self or body over and above anything else. A later author claims that what Yangzi valued was self in and of itself, while others described his thinking in the following way: “Keeping one’s nature whole, preserving one’s genuineness, and not letting things tire one’s form (body) – these Yangzi advocated but Mencius denounced.” In this example, the self to be valued consists in xing, the body, and in “genuineness” – a vague concept that seems to refer to a spiritual ideal – inherent or original to the individual. Based on such a description, Yang Zhu appears to have idealized certain aspects of the self that help define its essence, whether material, spiritual, or both. By insisting on a sharp separation between that which is internal or associated with the person on the one hand, and external things that might tire it on the other, Yang Zhu joins Mencius in basing his ideals on a fundamental inner/outer distinction. However, his recommendation that one keep the self and its aspects free of outside contamination, if accurate, would constitute an even more extreme form of individualism than what we have encountered with Mencius.

Like Zhuangzi, Yang Zhu (as characterized by later texts that attribute a certain, relatively consistent perspective to his beliefs) seems to have supported the preservation of some essential and vital spirit that is ultimately related to the human body and its wholeness. Unlike Zhuangzi, who wishes for individuals to transcend their own awareness of the boundaries of the self and its materiality, Yang Zhu appears to glorify the existence of these, and to call for the preservation of a strict separation between what is inside and belonging to the sphere of the self, and what is outside and belonging to the sphere of things. Thus, the main distinction between Zhuangzi and Yang Zhu lies in the fact that Yang Zhu appears to value the self as a material body that is sacred precisely because of its essential materiality and life-producing qualities. Zhuangzi, on the other hand, does not directly embrace the cult of bodily vitality. He calls for individuals to transcend their bodies and their materiality so as to embrace what he sometimes refers to as the spirit of the Dao, which should be understood as an ethereal type of vitality.

Given these descriptions of Yang Zhu’s thought, it seems fair to call him an individualist rather than an apologist for selfish egoism. After all, there is no convincing evidence that Yang Zhu promoted selfishness in the sense that he inspired individuals to seek self-profit through the exploitation of public resources or goods. Moreover, there is no clear indication that Yang Zhu tacitly condoned harming or destroying society through his ideals. Rather, most of the reliable evidence points to the fact that Yang Zhu redefined what it meant to value the self in terms of one’s personal, material-spiritual salvation. Indeed, Yang Zhu was perhaps one of the first thinkers, like Mencius, to see xing and the self as a primary source of idealized individual agency and meaning.

Individualism, as has been introduced here, was a broad orientation in early Chinese thought that posited the value and autonomy of the individual and, in some instances, located sources of idealized cosmic power and authority within the individual body. Widespread notions of self-cultivation viewed the individual as the key site of moral or spiritual transformation and, hence, the individual was the primary medium for assimilating social and cosmic authority and order. Early Chinese thinkers also presumed the moral or spiritual autonomy of the individual, granting individuals the power to effect changes in their lives and make important choices concerning morality, self-cultivation, and conformity to external sources of authority. Individualistic authors like Mencius, the Primitivist, and possibly Yang Zhu, went so far as to naturalize cosmic or divine sources of authority in the world by locating them within the human body itself. They thereby made the individual body the primary source for idealized agencies, and valued one’s cultivation of such innate agencies as the highest good.

8. References and Further Reading

Ames, Roger, and David L. Hall. “The Problematic of Self in Western Thought,” Thinking from the Han: Self, Truth, and Transcendence in Chinese and Western Culture. Albany: State University of New York Press, 1998.
Ames, Roger, Wimal Dissanayake, and Thomas Kasulis, ed. Self as Person in Asian Theory and Practice. Albany: State University of New York Press, 1994.
Ames, Roger, Wimal Dissanayake, and Thomas Kasulis, ed. Self as Image in Asian Theory and Practice. Albany: State University of New York Press, 1998.
Angle, Stephen. Human Rights in Chinese Thought: A Cross-Cultural Inquiry. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2002.
Bauer, Joanne and Daniel Bell, eds. The East Asian Challenge for Human Rights. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1999.
Bloom, Irene eds. “Confucian Perspectives on the Individual and the Collective,” Religious Diversity and Human Rights, Irene Bloom, J. Paul Martin, and Wayne L. Proudfoot, 114-151. New York: Columbia University Press, 1996.
Brindley, Erica. Individualism in Early China: Human Agency and the Self in Thought and Politics. University of Hawaii Press, 2010.
Chan, Joseph. “Moral Autonomy, Civil Liberties, and Confucianism,” Philosophy East and West, 52.3 (2002): 281-310.
Chen, Albert H. Y. “Is Confucianism Compatible with Liberal Constitutional Democracy?” Journal of Chinese Philosophy 35.2 (June 2007): 195-216.
Csikszentmihalyi, Mark. Material Virtue: Ethics and the Body in Early China. Leiden: Brill, 2004.
Emerson, John. “Yang Chu’s Discovery of the Body,” Philosophy East and West. 46.4 (1996): 533-566.
Graham, Angus C. Disputers of the Tao: Philosophical Argument in Ancient China. La Salle, IL: Open Court, 1989.
Graham, Angus C. “The Background of the Mencian Theory of Human Nature,” Tsing Hua Journal of Chinese Studies, vol. 6 (1957): pp. 215-271.
Greenwood, John. “Individualism and Collectivism in Moral and Social Thought,” The Moral Circle and the Self: Chinese and Western Approaches, eds., Kim-chong Chong, Sor-hoon Tan, and C. L. Ten, 163-73. La Salle, IL: Open Court, 2003.
Hansen, Chad. “Individualism in Chinese Thought,” Individualism and Holism: Studies in Confucian and Taoist Values, ed. Donald Munro, 35-55. Ann Arbor: Center for Chinese Studies, University of Michigan, 1985.
Ivanhoe, P. J. Confucian Moral Self Cultivation. New York: Peter Lang, 1993.
Kline, T. C. III and P. J. Ivanhoe, eds. Virtue, Nature, and Moral Agency in the Xunzi. Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing Company, Inc., 2000.
Kline, T. C. III. “Moral Agency and Motivation in the Xunzi,” Virtue, Nature, and Moral Agency in the Xunzi, eds. T. C. Kline III and P. J. Ivanhoe, 155-75. Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing Company, Inc., 2000.
Karyn Lai. “Understanding Change: The Interdependent Self in Its Environment,” New Interdisciplinary Perspectives in Chinese Philosophy, ed. Karyn Lai. Journal Supplement Series to the Journal of Chinese Philosophy (2007): 81-99.
Lin, Yüsheng. “The Evolution of the Pre-Confucian Meaning of Jen and the Confucian Concept of Moral Autonomy,” Monumenta Serica 31 (1974-75): 172-83.
Liu, Lydia H. “Translingual Practice: The Discourse of Individualism between China and the West,” Narratives of Agency: Self-making in China, India, and Japan, ed. Wimal Dissanayake. Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press, 1996.
Liu, Qingping. “Filiality versus Sociality and Individuality: On Confucianism as ‘Consanguinitism,” Philosophy East and West 53.2 (2003): 234-250.
Liu, Xiusheng. “Mengzian Internalism,” Essays on the Moral Philosophy of Mengzi, ed. Xiusheng Liu and Philip Ivanhoe, 101-31. Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing Co., Inc., 2002.
Munro, Donald. The Concept of Man in Early China, reprint. Ann Arbor: Center for Chinese Studies, University of Michigan, 2001.
Munro, Donald, ed. Individualism and Holism: Studies in Confucian and Taoist Values. Ann Arbor: Center for Chinese Studies, University of Michigan, 1985.
Nylan, Michael. “Confucian Piety and Individualism in Han China,” Journal of the American Oriental Society 116.1 (1996): 1-27.
Rosemont, Henry, Jr. “Rights-Bearing Individuals and Role-Bearing Persons,” Rules, Rituals, and Responsibility: Essays Dedicated to Herbert Fingarette, ed., Mary Bockover, 71-101. Chicago: Open Court, 1991.
Rosemont, Henry, Jr. “Who Chooses?” Chinese Texts and Philosophical Contexts, ed. Henry Rosemont, Jr., 227-263. LaSalle: Open Court, 1991.
“Two Loci of Authority: Autonomous Individuals and Related Persons,” Confucian Cultures of Authority, ed. Peter D. Hershock and Roger T. Ames, 1-20. Albany: State University of New York Press, 2006.
Roth, Harold. “Psychology and Self-Cultivation in Early Taoistic Thought,” Harvard Journal of Asiatic Studies 51.2 (1991): 599-650.
Rubin, Vitaly A. Individual and State in Ancient China: Essays on Four Chinese Philosophers. Trans. Steven I. Levine. New York: Columbia University Press, 1976.
Shun, Kwong-loi. “Conception of the Person in Early Confucian Thought,” Confucian Ethics: A Comparative Study of Self, Autonomy, and Community, eds., Kwong-loi Shun and David Wong, 183-99. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2004.
Shun, Kwong-loi and David Wong, ed. Confucian Ethics: A Comparative Study of Self, Autonomy, and Community. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2004.
Vinograd, Richard. Boundaries of the Self: Chinese Portraits, 1600-1900. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1992.
Wilson, Stephen A. “Conformity, Individuality, and the Nature of Virtue: A Classical Confucian Contribution to Contemporary Ethical Reflection,” Confucius and the Analects: New Essays, ed. Bryan W. Van Norden, 94-115. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2002.
Yearley, Lee. “Chuang Tzu’s Cosmic Identification,” Taoist Spirituality, Vol. 10 of World Spirituality: An Encyclopedic History of the Religious Quest, edited by Tu Wei-ming, New York: Crossroads, forthcoming.
Yu, Ying-shih. “Individualism and the Neo-Taoist Movement in Wei-Chin China,” Individualism and Holism: Studies in Confucian and Taoist Values, ed. Donald Munro. Ann Arbor: Center for Chinese Studies, University of Michigan, 1985.
Zhang Qianfang. “Human Dignity in Classical Chinese Philosophy: Reinterpreting Mohism,” Journal of Chinese Philosophy 34.2 (June 2007): 239-255.

Author Information

Erica Brindley
Email: efb12@psu.edu
The Pennsylvania State University
U. S. A.

Supervenience and Mind

This article is an informal introduction to the concept of supervenience and the role it plays in the philosophy of mind. It surveys some of the many ways the concept has been used to reveal the manner and degree to which mental phenomena depend on facts about our bodies and their physical features. Philosophers usually construe the supervenience relation as a relation between classes of properties, where a class of properties, F, supervenes on a class of properties, G, just in case there is no difference in F-properties without some difference in G-properties. As David Lewis puts it, “no difference of one sort without differences of another sort” (1986, p. 14). It is in the philosophy of mind that we find the term’s most frequent contemporary occurrence.

The goal of asking whether one set of properties supervenes on another is to better understand the ontological relation between the two sets — especially, whether the one set of properties depends entirely on the other. Suppose, for example, that two individuals can have different moral properties while being exactly alike in terms of their actual and potential behavior; that is, suppose that one’s moral features do not supervene on one’s behavioral features. Then we can conclude that the former depend on something more than the latter. And if we accept this conclusion, we are then led to search for a set of properties on which our moral features do supervene, a set of properties in terms of which any two individuals must differ with any moral difference. The goal is to isolate just that set of features on which our moral properties do wholly rely.

Suppose we succeed in identifying a set of features on which F-properties supervene (where F-properties might be moral, mental, aesthetic, economic, or any other higher-level properties). Then we can try to discover the nature of the dependence of F-properties on the underlying G-properties (for example, behavioral, physical, neurological, or intrinsic) by asking about the manner in which the former supervene on the latter. Is it a logical truth that a difference in F-properties requires a difference in G-properties? Is this covariance due to the causal laws that actually obtain? Is it a matter of metaphysical necessity? Asking these questions about the way in which F-properties supervene may help us decide whether the dependence is, for example, a wholly analytic affair, a type of causal dependence, a matter of constitution, or a matter of genuine identity.

Supervenience: The Basic Idea
Supervenience and Non-Reductive Physicalism
Varieties of Supervenience
1. Global and Local Versions
2. Varieties of Necessitation
Two Common Complaints with Supervenience Theses
1. Explanatory Failure
2. Ontological Failure
Concluding Remarks
References and Further Readings

1. Supervenience: The Basic Idea

Nora’s latest sculpture has many intrinsic features, including its shape, density, texture, and constituent matter. It also has various aesthetic properties — beauty, grace, elegance, and expressive power. No doubt, the aesthetic properties of the sculpture are in some way and to some degree a result of its intrinsic features. But in what way exactly, and to what degree? Thinking in terms of supervenience is a good start to finding the answer. Imagine an artwork, x*, that is intrinsically indistinguishable from Nora’s sculpture, x — a perfect duplicate of x. Is it possible that despite the indiscernability, x* might differ aesthetically from x? If it is not possible for x and the intrinsically indiscernable x* to differ aesthetically, then we say that the object’s aesthetic features supervene on its intrinsic features, where a class of properties, F, supervenes on a class of properties, G, just in case a difference in F-properties requires a difference in G-properties; in other words, all the same G-properties guarantee all the same F-properties.

If we decide that the object’s aesthetic properties do supervene on its intrinsic features, then we are led to inquire whether the former are identical with the latter or whether the dependence relation is of some weaker sort — for example, causal dependence or constitution. On the other hand, if we conclude that the object’s aesthetic properties do not supervene on its intrinsic features, that is, if x* might differ aesthetically from x despite their intrinsic similarity, then we can conclude that those aesthetic properties are at least partly a function of certain relations the object bears to external items. We are then led to ask what the relevant external relations are. We think in terms of supervenience again, imagining various changes in x’s environment (different origins, differences in historical context, different standards of the qualified judges, differences in popular opinion), and for each of those changes we decide whether x’s aesthetic features might also differ, until we isolate just those features of the environment on which the aesthetic properties do rely. The conclusion would then be that the object’s aesthetic features supervene on its intrinsic properties together with those external features.

As this line of inquiry shows, the concept of supervenience is an invaluable tool for deciding whether and how one set of properties depends on another. An analogous line of inquiry is found in discussions of mental content. The content of one’s mental states depends largely on what the individual is like internally — on the state of the brain and the brain’s causal relations to other parts of the body, including sense organs and limbs. But does the content of one’s mental states depend entirely on these intrinsic features? To decide this issue, we consider whether it is possible for an indistinguishable individual, a molecule-for-molecule duplicate, to differ in terms of the content of her mental states. And thanks to the thought experiments of Hilary Putnam (1973, 1975) and Tyler Burge (1979), it is widely thought that intrinsic duplicates can indeed differ in the content of their mental states. Putnam has us imagine a twin-earth that is exactly like earth except that what they call “water” on twin-earth is comprised of something other than H₂O molecules. The content of your water-thoughts, it seems, differs from the content of your doppelganger’s “water”-thoughts on twin-earth — simply because of the difference in the liquid toward which those thoughts are directed. (But note that Putnam’s example is actually designed to show a difference in linguistic content, meaning, which does not in itself entail a difference in mental content.) Likewise, Burge shows that given suitable differences in surrounding linguistic practice, the thoughts one expresses with the word ‘arthritis’ might differ in content from those that one’s doppelganger expresses. For example, if your duplicate inhabits a possible world in which ‘arthritis’ is regularly used to describe various conditions in addition to inflammation of the joints, then it seems that the content of the duplicate’s ‘arthritis’ thoughts will differ from yours. Examples such as these seem to show that the content of one’s mental states does not supervene on one’s intrinsic features alone, but only on a set of features that includes features of one’s environment.

While Putnam and Burge do not use the term ‘supervenience’ in the essays mentioned above (though Burge does use it in his 1986 discussion of externalism), it is clear that the concept of “no difference of one sort without differences of another sort” is being utilized. It was Davidson’s use of ‘supervenience’ in “Mental Events” (1970) that made the term popular in the philosophy of mind.

2. Supervenience and Non-Reductive Physicalism

While Davidson denies that there are psychophysical laws, he acknowledges (in a widely cited passage) that

mental characteristics are in some sense dependent, or supervenient, on physical characteristics. Such supervenience might be taken to mean that there cannot be two events alike in all physical respects but differing in some mental respect, or that an object cannot alter in some mental respect without altering in some physical respect” (1970, p. 88).

Not long after the appearance of Davidson’s essay, discussions of Non-Reductive Physicalism became the major locus of supervenience-talk in the philosophy of mind and the philosophical literature in general. Due to the popularity of functionalist accounts of mentality and the wide degree of multiple realizability they entail (that is, that the same mental property can be realized by events of different physical, chemical, and neural types), a dominant view in the philosophy of mind for the past few decades is the belief that mental properties are not identical with neural properties or any other properties of the natural sciences. Yet, many of those who reject psychophysical property-identities also claim to support Physicalism regarding mentality, the view that all mental phenomena obtain solely by virtue of physical phenomena. One wonders: how can mentality obtain solely by virtue of physical phenomena, as Physicalism maintains, if mental properties are not physical? The most popular answer is that while mental properties are not identical with physical properties, they nonetheless depend on nothing other than physical properties — that is, they supervene on physical properties.

Whether a mental-physical supervenience thesis captures the content of Physicalism regarding mentality depends on how exactly the supervenience relation is to be understood. To say that there is no mental difference without some physical difference leaves the matter rather unclear. Much of the literature on supervenience in the philosophy of mind is devoted to adding the needed precision. Let us consider some of the many issues that arise.

3. Varieties of Supervenience

The philosophical literature is replete with all manner of ways to describe the supervenience relation — “an unlovely proliferation,” as Lewis puts it (1986, p. 14). Here are some of the most popular brands.

a. Global and Local Versions

John Haugeland expresses the idea that all properties supervene on physical properties as follows: “[t]he world could not have been different in any respect, without having been different in some strictly physical respect” (1984, p. 1). This is a global supervenience thesis, claiming that nonphysical difference entails physical difference at the level of possible worlds as a whole (where a possible world is a way the world could have been, which includes the actual world, the way the world actually is). Applied to mental and physical properties, Haugeland’s global supervenience claim is that the total state of any possible world could not have been any different mentally without differing physically. That is,

(GS) for any possible worlds, w₁ and w₂, if w₁ and w₂ differ mentally, then w₁ and w₂ differ physically.

Equivalently, if w₁ and w₂ are exactly the same physically, then they are exactly the same mentally.

While GS goes a long way toward capturing the physicalist belief that the mental depends entirely on the physical, it is arguable that it does not go far enough. Kim (1987, p. 321) has us imagine that some possible world b differs physically from the actual world in only the following respect: in b one of Saturn’s rings contains an additional ammonia molecule. GS requires mental similarity only between worlds that are physically indistinguishable as a whole. So despite the slight and innocuous physical difference between b and the actual world, GS allows that b mentally differs from the actual world as greatly as you please, perhaps being completely devoid of mentality. This result clearly goes against the physicalist intuition that mental phenomena obtain solely by virtue of physical phenomena. For in the case Kim describes, all of the physical features that are relevant to mentality remain constant. So it seems that if b differs mentally from the actual world, as GS allows, then whatever mental differences there are would have to be due to something other than physical differences. (Note that several authors identify and formulate different types of global supervenience; for a thorough description of varieties of global supervenience, see McLaughlin and Bennett, 2006. These complexities are ignored in this introductory survey; here the concern is with global supervenience in general.)

To come closer to capturing the content of Physicalism regarding the mind, a supervenience thesis needs to require not only that worlds differing mentally differ physically, but also that individual objects and events cannot differ mentally without differing physically. Consider, then, the following local supervenience thesis:

(LS) for any worlds, w₁ and w₂, and any individuals, x in w₁ and y in w₂, if x in w₁ differs mentally from y in w₂, then x in w₁ differs physically from y in w₂.

Or one might choose what Kim (1984) calls “strong” supervenience. To say that mental properties strongly supervene on physical properties is to say that

(SS) necessarily, for any mental property M, and any individual x that has M, there is a physical property (or set of physical properties) P, such that x has P, and necessarily, for any individual y, if y has P, then y has M.

The difference between LS and SS is that LS allows the possibility that some entities have mental properties without having any physical properties. (Yet, SS and LS are equivalent when the base set of physical properties is closed under negation, that is, when for every physical property P in the base set, its negation, ~P, is also included.)

Now suppose that Carla and Marla inhabit worlds that are physically indistinguishable in every respect except for the extra ammonia molecule in a ring of Saturn. While the worlds themselves differ physically, Carla and Marla do not. So unlike GS, LS and SS entail that Carla and Marla are mentally indistinguishable. So it seems that LS and SS better capture the physicalist intuition that mental facts obtain solely in virtue of physical facts. (However, there is some debate over whether the global thesis might actually be equivalent to SS given the right closure principles. See, for example, Petrie, 1987, Kim, 1987, Paull & Sider, 1992, and Stalnaker, 1996.)

Note that SS differs from Kim’s formulation of what he calls “weak” supervenience (WS), which lacks the second occurrence of the word ‘necessarily.’

(WS) necessarily, for any mental property M, and any individual x that has M, there is a physical property (or set of physical properties) P, such that x has P, and for any individual y, if y has P, then y has M.

Unlike SS and LS, WS requires only that physical duplicates are mental duplicates within possible worlds, thereby allowing that physical duplicates differ mentally across possible worlds. So unlike SS and LS, WS allows that you could have had different mental properties from those you actually have without differing in any physical way. But if you could have had different mental properties without differing physically in any way, then the mental facts about you do not depend solely on the way you are physically, which seems to be contrary to Physicalism. Thus, SS and LS are preferable to WS.

As indicated above, by not allowing that Carla and Marla differ mentally, LS and SS might seem preferable to GS. However, one might think that given externalist intuitions, GS is more desirable. If externalism regarding mental content is correct, then individuals that are the same in terms of their intrinsic physical properties are not guaranteed to be mentally the same. GS honors externalist intuitions by requiring sameness only at the level of whole worlds, thereby allowing individuals with all the same intrinsic physical properties to differ mentally. However, Kim (1987, pp. 322-4) points out that the strong supervenience thesis, SS, can also allow the truth of externalism simply by including extrinsic properties of individuals in the supervenience base, properties such as being causally related to stuff comprised of H₂O. If the underlying physical properties, the subvening properties, include relations to external items, then LS can also accommodate externalist intuitions. (Although, we cannot let just any extrinsic property into the supervenience base. If we allow the extrinsic feature of occupying a world with such-and-such complete physical profile, then the strong and local supervenience theses automatically collapse into the global version. For in that case, having all the same mental properties is not required unless the individuals occupy worlds that are physically indistinguishable in every respect. Vera Hoffmann and Albert Newen, 2007, develop the idea of property-dependent supervenience as a way to include only those extrinsic properties that are relevant to the instantiation of a higher-level property.)

We saw that one worry about GS is that it allows great mental differences to be accompanied by what seem to be wholly irrelevant physical differences — allowing, for example, that Carla and Marla differ mentally despite their physical similarity, simply because in Marla’s world there is one more ammonia molecule in one of the rings of Saturn. LS and SS prevent this possibility but they still fall short of fully capturing physicalist intuitions since differences irrelevant to one’s mentality are to be found not only in distant regions of space. Suppose that Carla and Marla live in physically indistinguishable environments and their bodies are physically indistinguishable in all but the following respect: Marla has an additional electron in one of her toenails. Since this cuticle difference seems to be completely irrelevant to mentality, we would expect that Carla and Marla are mentally indistinguishable. However, since they are not physically indistinguishable, LS and SS allow vast mental differences between the two. This result seems contrary to the spirit of Physicalism since Carla and Marla are physically indistinguishable in all the ways that are relevant to mentality.

The move from GS to LS and SS is an attempt to isolate those physical properties that are relevant to the exemplification of a mental property. For a more successful attempt, one might appeal to Terence Horgan’s regional supervenience thesis. With his notion of a P-region, a spatio-temporal region of a physically possible world, Horgan expresses his regional supervenience thesis as: “There are no two P-regions that are exactly alike in all qualitative intrinsic physical features but different in some other qualitative intrinsic feature” (1993a, p. 571). (Also see Horgan 1982, p. 37). Consider the region of space occupied by Marla’s whole body minus the toenail with the extra electron and the region of space occupied by the corresponding part of Carla’s body. Since these two regions are physically indistinguishable, the regional supervenience thesis yields the correct result that Carla-minus (Carla minus the toenail) does not differ mentally from Marla-minus. This result together with the fact that there is no mentality supervening on the physical features of the toenail itself yields that further desired conclusion that Marla as a whole is mentally the same as Carla as a whole. (By the way, those mental and other higher-order states that require an externalist individuation will supervene on the intrinsic features of an expanded region of space, which Horgan points out, is “a region large enough to encompass, as intrinsic features, all the contextually relevant facts”: 1982, p. 39.)

Another way to isolate just those physical features that are relevant to mentality is to utilize Kim’s notion of a B-minimal property. A property is B-minimal when “any property weaker than it is not a supervenience base” (1984, p. 165). If a physical property, P, is B-minimal with respect to mental property M, then P is a least sufficient condition for M — that is, P’s instantiation guarantees M’s instantiation, and there is no proper constituent of P an instance of which guarantees an instance of M. The properties that are B-minimal with respect to M do not include the number of electrons in one’s toenails. Thus, with only B-minimal properties in the supervenience base, Carla and Marla have all the same subvening properties despite their cuticle difference, which guarantees that they have all the same mental properties. Suppose, then, that we strengthen LS and SS to read:

(LS*) for any mental property M, there is a physical property P that is B-minimal with respect to M, such that for any possible worlds, w₁ and w₂, and any individuals x in w₁ and y in w₂, if x in w₁ differs from y in w₂ in terms of M, then x in w₁ differs from y in w₂ in terms of P

and

(SS*) necessarily, for any mental property M, and any individual x that has M, there is a physical property (or set of physical properties) P, such that (i) x has P, (ii) P is B-minimal with respect to M, and (ii) necessarily, for any individual y, if y has P, then y has M,

respectively. Since no physical property that is B-minimal property with respect to M includes having an extra electron in a toenail, neither LS* nor SS* allows that Carla and Marla differ mentally, which is just as Physicalism seems to require given that they are physically indistinguishable in all respects relevant to mentality.

Jeffrey Poland’s (1994) formulation of Physicalism further narrows the class of relevant base properties by adding the notion of a B-minimal property to a regional supervenience thesis. Poland worries that a physical property might qualify as a B-minimal supervenience base with respect to some higher-level (for example, mental) property without being the property by virtue of which the higher-level property is instantiated. To remedy this defect Poland proposes that “[f]or each non-physical attribute, N, and for each region of space-time, R, if N is actually (or possibly) instantiated in R, then there exists a minimal class of physically-based attributes, P, such that the instantiation of the members of P does (or would) provide a realization of N on that occasion” (p. 191).

Apart from deciding which of these supervenience theses to endorse, there is another issue that needs to be addressed. In formulating a supervenience thesis adequate for understanding the ontological relation between two sets of properties, we need to decide which brand of modality is to figure in our formulation? How should the necessity operators in WS, SS, and SS* be interpreted, and what is the range of the possible worlds mentioned in GS, LS, and LS*?

b. Varieties of Necessitation

Suppose it is true that whenever there is a mental difference there is a physical difference. It would seem that this is not merely an accidental fact, not merely a matter of the way things happen to be. Rather it seems that the physical facts that obtain in some way necessitate the mental facts that obtain:

(N) facts about the distribution of physical properties necessitate all the facts about the distribution of mental properties.

But what brand of necessity is at issue here? Answering this modal question is essential to understanding how the mental depends on the physical. The answer is also crucial to deciding whether a supervenience thesis can adequately capture all that Physicalism regarding mentality entails.

The physical facts clearly do not logically necessitate the mental facts. The laws of logic alone do not allow us to derive the latter from the former. However, one might wonder whether the laws of logic together with the meanings of physical and mental terms allow us to derive all true mentalistic sentences from sentences expressed in physical vocabulary. That is, one might wonder whether

(N_L-C) facts about the distribution of physical properties logically/conceptually necessitate all the facts about the distribution of mental properties.

Yet, N_L-C seems implausible on any reasonable interpretation of ‘physical.’ If we restrict the term ‘physical’ to properties described by the science of physics itself, then the obvious difference in meaning between mental vocabulary and the vocabulary of physics seems to show that N_L-C is false. Even if the word ‘physical’ were used loosely enough to include brain properties, and even if mental properties were identical with brain properties, N_L-C would still be highly dubious. Since mental talk is not synonymous with neural talk, mind-brain identity theorists rightly held their view, not as an analytic truth, but as a significant empirical hypothesis. (See, for example, J.J.C. Smart, 1959 and U.T. Place, 1956.) Suppose ‘physical’ is used liberally enough to include overt behavioral responses to environmental input — for example, bringing an umbrella when confronted with rain, grimacing and groaning as the punching continues, and responding appropriately in French to questions posed in French. With this liberal use of ‘physical’ N_L-C would be accepted by logical behaviorists. Of course, this is no credit to N_L-C given the well-known problems with logical behaviorism. Although, one might think that with such a generous use of ‘physical,’ analytic functionalism (which is not as implausible as logical behaviorism) is committed to N_L-C as well. But that is not so. Functionalists characterize mental properties in terms of their relations to environmental input, behavioral output, and other mental properties. For instance, the belief that it is raining will be characterized in terms of an inclination to bring an umbrella if one wishes to keep dry. Given that mental predicates are to be interdefined, even with a liberal definition of ‘physical’ the analytic functionalist would seem compelled to deny that a purely physical description logically/conceptually guarantees the truth of any mental description.

Not only does N_L-C seem to be false, it also appears to be much more than what Physicalism requires. It might be that mental phenomena depend entirely on physical phenomena (as physicalists regarding mentality contend) without there being a logical or conceptual tie between the two. Since predicates that differ in meaning might denote the very same property, it seems that even if mental properties were identical with physical properties, it would not follow that facts about the latter logically or conceptually guarantee facts about the former. (However, Robert Kirk claims otherwise. Imagine the complete set, P, of facts about the world expressed in the vocabulary of an ideal physics, and suppose that this set includes all of the physical laws that obtain. According to Kirk, Physicalism requires that the relation between P and the set of mental facts is one of strict implication, where “statement A strictly implies a statement B just in case ‘A and not-B’ involves inconsistency of a broadly logical or conceptual kind,” 2006, p. 525. There are also the arguments of Jackson (1994 & 1998) and Chalmers’ (1996) to consider, arguments purporting to show that much more follows a priori from the physical facts than what we might be inclined to think. Although, for Chalmers and Jackson, these do not include facts about the qualitative character of conscious experience.)

The fact that mental differences require physical differences would seem to have something, perhaps everything, to do with the laws of nature that actually obtain. It is arguable that the laws of nature that actually obtain are what make it the case that mental sameness guarantees physical sameness. Consider, then, the proposal that:

(N_N) facts about the distribution of physical properties nomologically necessitate all the facts about the distribution of mental properties.

However, while it is reasonable to think that the supervenience of the mental on the physical is a matter of the laws of nature that actually obtain, N_N is too weak to do the work a physicalist would want a supervenience thesis to do. The physicalist who appeals to supervenience is trying to honor the fact that the mental depends entirely on the physical without being committed to the view that mental properties are identical with physical properties. Suppose, as is widely believed, that mental properties are not identical with physical properties. Then the psychophysical laws by virtue of which the physical facts fix the mental facts are not purely physical laws. In that case, N_N allows that there is a possible world that is physically indistinguishable from the actual world, including all the same purely physical laws, but with a very different distribution of mental properties. As Crane puts it, “if fixing the mental facts requires psychophysical laws, then fixing the physical facts alone is not sufficient to fix the mental facts” (1991, pp. 237-8).

To support our physicalist intuitions, it seems that we need a supervenience relation that is committed to the following necessitation claim:

(N_P) facts about the distribution of physical properties physically necessitate all the facts about the distribution of mental properties,

where p physically necessitates q just in case ‘p and not q’ is not true in any possible world with all the same physical laws as those that actually obtain. If the physical laws did allow worlds with the same distribution of physical properties but a different distribution of mental properties, then there would be a clear sense in which the mental facts are at least partly due to something other than physical facts. So it is arguable that our physicalist intuitions do entail just what N_P states. Indeed, N_p does capture a popular way that the necessity involved in supervenience theses applied to mentality are in fact understood. (See, for example, Papineau’s formulation of Physicalism: 1993, p. 21.)

Yet, there are some worries about N_P. Lewis, Horgan, and Jackson address what is called the Problem of Extras. Lewis claims that “Materialism is meant to be a contingent thesis, a merit of our world that not all other worlds share” (1983, p. 362). Even if all concrete phenomena obtain solely by virtue of physical phenomena, as Physicalism maintains, it seems that things did not have to be that way. The world could have been such that angels, ghosts, or other immaterial beings reside alongside the physical items that actually exist. It is also arguable that Physicalism allows non-actual possible worlds where all the actual physical laws obtain but with immaterial extras — provided that these extras do not causally interfere with the physical world. Horgan imagines that “[i]n such worlds the spirits would not interfere with the ordinary operations of physical laws upon physical substances; they would simply co-exist with the physical” (1982, p. 35). The concern, then, is that a possible world with the same distribution of physical properties that actually obtains and all the same physical laws might nonetheless differ from the actual world by having immaterial mental extras. If such a possible world is consistent with the truth of Physicalism, as Lewis and Horgan think, then the truth of Physicalism does not require that physical sameness (including physical laws) guarantees mental sameness. And if so, then N_P is not necessary for the truth of Physicalism.

One way to solve the Problem of Extras is to identify some restricted class of physically possible worlds and then characterize Physicalism as the view that physical sameness entails mental (and other higher-order) sameness in that restricted class of worlds. For example, Frank Jackson (1998) appeals to the notion of a minimal physical duplicate, where “a minimal physical duplicate of our world is a world that (a) is exactly like our world in every physical respect (instantiated property for instantiated property, law for law, relation for relation), and (b) contains nothing else in the sense of nothing more by way of kinds or particulars than it must to satisfy (a)” (p. 13). With this notion of a minimal physical duplicate, Jackson proposes that we characterize Physicalism in general as the view that “[a]ny world which is a minimal physical duplicate of our world is a duplicate simpliciter of our world” (p. 12). That is, if you physically duplicate the actual world and stop right there, then what results does not differ mentally or in any other way from the actual world. To restrict the class of physically possible worlds where physical sameness entails mental sameness, Lewis (1983) relies on the notion of a property’s being “alien” to a world, where “a property is alien to a world iff (1) it is not instantiated by any inhabitant of that world, and (2) it is not analysable as a conjunction of, or as a structural property constructed out of, natural properties all of which are instantiated by inhabitants of that world” (p. 364). With the notion of an alien property, Lewis offers the following supervenience claim: “[a]mong worlds where no natural properties alien to our world are instantiated, no two differ without differing physically; any two such worlds that are exactly alike physically are duplicates” (p. 364). If we think that a physically possible world with the distribution of physical properties that actually obtains might nonetheless contain immaterial mental extras, then we might restrict N_P with the help of either Lewis’ proposal or Jackson’s (or Horgan’s proposal, which appeals to the notion of a physically accessible world, a P-world, 1982, p. 36-7).

Another potential concern about N_P is expressed by Francescotti (2000, 1998). Suppose, as many believe, that mental properties are not identical with physical properties. Then the purely physical laws do not range over mental properties. In that case, Francescotti argues, the physical properties instantiated would determine which mental properties are instantiated only given the truth of irreducibly psychophysical laws. But if so, it is arguable that the truth of N_p requires that mental properties are identical with physical properties (which seems to be a threat to Non-Reductive Physicalism assuming that Physicalism requires the physical necessitation of mental facts).

The search for the exact way in which the physical facts necessitate the mental facts continues. There are also the remaining issues described in section 3-a — whether to prefer local to global supervenience, and whether and how to make the thesis super-local to capture only those physical properties that are relevant to mentality. There is also the issue of whether the supervenience base should be restricted to qualitative properties or whether non-qualitative, impure properties should also be included — properties such as containing a neural event that is numerically identical with neural event x. (Recall that Horgan’s regional supervenience thesis is restricted to qualitative properties.) There is also the question of whether it is acceptable for a supervenience thesis to be restricted to same-subject necessitation, where the base properties are restricted to properties of the very same object that bears the supervening properties. Should we prefer multiple-domain supervenience (where the supervening properties are exemplified by a domain of items that differs from the domain of the subvening properties) — allowing, for example, that the base properties are properties of constituents of the individuals with the supervening properties? While supervenience theorists have been dealing for years with these technical matters and many others regarding the details of the supervenience relation, some general objections have been raised to the whole project of trying to describe the dependence of the mental on the physical in terms of supervenience. Let’s consider two common complaints.

4. Two Common Complaints with Supervenience Theses

Kim (1993) tells us that a supervenience thesis “itself says nothing about the nature of the dependence involved; it tells us neither what kind of dependency it is, nor how the dependency grounds or explains the property covariation” (pp. 165-6). So a supervenience thesis leaves us wondering:

Is it a matter of causal dependence? Is it in some way analogous to mereological supervenience? Is it after all a matter of meaning dependence, as logical behaviorists and some functionalists claim? Perhaps, a matter of divine intervention or plan as Malebranche and Leibniz thought? Or a brute and in principle unexplainable relationship which we must accept “with natural piety,” as some emergentists used to insist? (p. 167)

There are two distinct worries expressed here — the failure of a supervenience thesis to explain mental phenomena and its failure to ontologically ground mental phenomena.

a. Explanatory Failure

If the mental supervenes on the physical as a matter of logical-conceptual necessity, then there would be an easy explanation (in terms of the laws of logic and meanings of our mental and physical terms) for why physical sameness guarantees mental sameness. Yet, if N_L-C is to be rejected, as it seems it should, then the worry is that the dependence of the mental on the physical is left unexplained. One might appeal to psychophysical laws as the explanation — P guarantees M because it is a law that P → N. But this does not explain why the psychophysical law P → N obtains. The complaint that an account expressed solely in terms of supervenience commits us to unexplained psychophysical laws has been raised by many. See, for example, Gardner (2005, p. 201-2), Kim (1989, sec. IV, 1993, pp. 165-9), Heil, (1998), Horgan (1993a, sec. 8, 1993b, sec. 5), and Moreland (1998, pp. 50-1). A physicalist might allow that there are brute laws, provided that these are purely physical. But if a law is not purely physical, if it is irreducibly psychophysical, then as a physicalist one would expect an explanation in terms of purely physical laws of why that psychophysical law obtains, and this explanation is what a mere supervenience claim does not provide. As a result, a physicalist might be compelled to find some suitable brand of what Horgan calls “superdupervenience” — “ontological supervenience that is robustly explainable in a materialistically acceptable way” (1993, p. 577).

Regarding the explanatory concern, two points are worth mentioning. First, if we are offering an ontological account of mentality, then it is not clear that a “materialistically acceptable” explanation is required. According to Physicalism as an ontological doctrine, mental (and other higher-level) phenomena obtain solely by virtue of physical phenomena. However, it might be that mental phenomena are entirely due to physical phenomena in a way that is inexplicable to us. So if our concern is with the ontological status of mentality, then it is arguably not a fault of a supervenience-based account that it falls short of superdupervenience. Secondly, it seems that a supervenience thesis by itself can take us some way, perhaps a long way, toward understanding the nature of the psychophysical dependence. Recall that an adequate formulation of a supervenience thesis will need to make clear what brand of necessity is involved. Suppose that mental properties supervene on physical properties with physical necessity. Then the purely physical laws that actually obtain provide the explanation of why changes in mental properties require changes in physical properties. Suppose that mental properties supervene on physical properties with nomological necessity only. Then the explanation of why the mental supervenes on the physical would appeal to irreducibly psychophysical laws. This explanation might not (and should not) satisfy a physicalist, but it is an explanation nonetheless, and perhaps even the correct explanation. Or maybe the physical facts fix the mental facts with a type of necessity that lies between the logical/conceptual variety and the physical brand — with the metaphysical necessity that some philosophers discuss. Then we might decide that the mental supervenes on the physical, not because of the physical laws that actually obtain, but due to some other type of relation, perhaps identity or maybe some mereological (part-whole) relation. It seems, then, that thinking about the modality involved in a supervenience thesis can profitably guide our thoughts about why mental properties covary with physical properties in the way that they do.

There is another reason, and perhaps a better reason than explanatory failure, to be dissatisfied with a mere supervenience thesis.

b. Ontological Failure

Since a mental-physical supervenience thesis tells us only how mental properties covary with physical properties, it is compatible not only with property dualism (as the non-reductive physicalist would hope) but also with substance dualism. Even if substance dualism were true, it might be that immaterial minds are causally connected or otherwise related to physical bodies in such a way that any variation in the properties of these immaterial minds occurs only with a variation in physical properties of the body. Physicalism certainly does not allow that substance dualism is true. So, since a supervenience thesis is compatible with substance dualism, it does not fully capture our physicalist intuitions.

However, there is still hope for an adequate formulation of Physicalism regarding mentality that is largely supervenience-based. To avoid substance dualism, we simply need to conjoin a supervenience thesis with some constraint on the composition of mental items. For example, as Geoffrey Hellman and Frank Thompson (1975) state with their Principle of Physical Exhaustion, “everything concrete is exhausted by basic physical objects” (p. 555). Likewise, Phillip Pettit (1993) insists that “[e]verything in the empirical world is composed in some way — composed without remainder — out of (subatomic) entities of the kind that microphysics posits, or it is itself uncomposed and microphysical” (p. 215). Applied to mentality, the claim is: all mental particulars (all instances and bearers of mental properties) are ultimately comprised entirely of physical particulars.

Or we might wish to combine a supervenience thesis with a realization claim. The claim that mental properties are realized physically is popular among those who support Physicalism while denying psychophysical identities. The notion of physical realization adds to the Principle of Physical Exhaustion the idea that mental properties are functional properties that are exemplified by virtue of instances of physical properties playing the definitive functional roles. So the idea that mental properties are realized physically would also seem to rule out immaterial mental items. (Indeed, Andrew Melynk, for example, 1996, 2003, and 2006, argues that a realization thesis itself, suitably refined, is enough to capture the content of Physicalism even without an independent supervenience claim.)

5. Concluding Remarks

It is widely agreed that the notion of supervenience cannot by itself fully explain the dependence of the mental on the physical. Yet, we must not underestimate the value of the concept to understanding how mental properties relate to the physical properties on which they depend. Whether or not we actually use the term ‘supervenience,’ our first step in deciding whether F-properties depend solely on G-properties is to decide whether a difference in the former requires a difference in the latter. On the basis of various thought-experiments, we might conclude that (i) F-properties do not supervene on G-properties, that is, that the former are not entirely a function of the latter (as many conclude regarding the relation between mental content and intrinsic bodily features). While (i) is a negative result, it is quite useful insofar as it directs our attention to features, perhaps previously overlooked, on which F-properties do depend (for example, surrounding linguistic practice or the internal structure of the external objects of our thought). Suppose, on the other hand, we conclude that F-properties do supervene on G-properties. Establishing this conclusion is an essential step to concluding further that (ii) F-properties are identical with G-properties (since any set of properties trivially supervenes on itself). Or instead of (ii), we might conclude that (iii) F-properties depend entirely on but are not identical with G-properties. Whichever of (i)-(iii) we choose, that choice inevitably involves deciding whether supervenience obtains.

Regarding the mental and the physical, we might decide either that (ii*) mental properties are physical properties or that (iii*) while non-physical, mental properties nonetheless depend entirely on physical properties. Being a physicalist regarding mentality seems to require accepting at least (iii*). And since both (ii*) and (iii*) entail that the mental supervenes on the physical, it seems Kim is right to note that “mind-body supervenience represents the minimal physicalist commitment” (1993, p. 168). A supervenience thesis, however, is not merely a minimal physicalist commitment, for it need not leave the mental-physical covariance wholly unexplained. Suppose we accept (ii*). Then we have a simple explanation of the covariance: changes in the mental require changes in the physical simply because the mental is the physical. On the other hand, if we accept (iii*), then as noted in section 3-a, thinking about the brand of necessity involved in our supervenience thesis (conceptual, metaphysical, physical, or nomological) can take us some way, perhaps a long way, toward figuring out what type of dependence obtains. And since even making a decision regarding (i)-(iii), or (ii*)-(iii*), requires engaging in thoughts about supervenience, the concept is not only helpful, but indispensible to understanding the relation between the two sets of properties. So whether or not the term ‘supervenience’ remains in vogue, the very notion will remain a crucial and potentially highly useful part of our inquiry into the relation between the mental and the physical. As Dean Rickles, another writer for this encyclopedia puts it, “supervenience deserves the central place that is has found in the philosophers’ toolbox” (2006).

6. References and Further Readings

Beckermann, A., H. Flohr, and J. Kim (1992). Emergence or Reduction? Essays on the Prospects of Nonreductive Physicalism (Berlin: Walter de Gruyter).
Bennett, K. (2004). “Global Supervenience and Dependence,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 68: 510-529.
Burge, T. (1979). “Individualism and the Mental,” Midwest Studies in Philosophy 4: 73-121.
Burge, T. (1986). “Individualism and Psychology,” The Philosophical Review 95: 3-45.
Chalmers, D. (1996). The Conscious Mind (New York: Oxford University Press).
Chalmers, D. and F. Jackson (2001). “Conceptual Analysis and Reductive Explanation,” Philosophical Review 110: 15-60.
Crane, T. (1991). “All God Has To Do,” Analysis 51: 235-244.
Davidson, D. (1970). “Mental Events,” in L. Foster and J. W. Swanson (eds.), Experience and Theory (Amherst, MA: University of Massachusetts Press): 79-101.
Francescotti, R. (2000). “Ontological Physicalism and Property Pluralism: Why They are Incompatible,” Pacific Philosophical Quarterly 81: 349-362.
Francescotti (1998). “The Non-Reductionist’s Troubles with Supervenience,” Philosophical Studies 89: 105-124.
Gardner, T. (2005). “Supervenience Physicalism: Meeting the Demands of Determination and Explanation,” Philosophical Papers 34: 189-208.
Hare, R.M. (1952). The Language of Morals (Oxford: Oxford University Press).
Haugeland, J. (1984). “Ontological Supervenience,” The Southern Journal of Philosophy, Supplement 22: 1-12.
Heil, J. (1998). “Supervenience Deconstructed,” European Journal of Philosophy 6: 146-155.
Hellman, G. and F. W. Thompson, (1975). “Physicalism: Ontology, Determination, and Reduction,” The Journal of Philosophy 72: 551-564.
Hoffmann-Kolss, V. (2010). The Metaphysics of Extrinsic Properties (Frankfurt: Ontos Verlag).
Hoffmann, V. and A. Newen (2007). “Supervenience of Extrinsic Properties,” Erkenntnis 67: 305-319.
Hofweber, T. (2005). “Supervenience and Object-Dependent Properties,” The Journal of Philosophy 102: 5-32.
Horgan, T. (1993a). “From Supervenience to Superdupervenience: Meeting the Demands of a Material World,” Mind 102: 555-586.
Horgan, T. (1993b). “Nonreductive Materialism and the Explanatory Autonomy of Psychology,” in S. J. Wagner and R. Warner (eds.), Naturalism (Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press): 295-320.
Horgan, T. (ed.) (1984). Southern Journal of Philosophy 22: The Spindel Conference 1983 Supplement, Supervenience.
Horgan, T. (1982). “Supervenience and Microphysics,” Pacific Philosophical Quarterly 63: 29-43.
Howell, R. J. (2009). “Emergentism and Supervenience Physicalism,” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 87: 83-98.
Jackson, F. (1998). From Metaphysics to Ethics: A Defence of Conceptual Analysis (Oxford: Clarendon Press).
Jackson, F. (1994). “Armchair Metaphysics,” in M. Michael and J. O’Leary-Hawthorne (eds.), Philosophy in Mind, (Dordrecht: Kluwer): 23-42.
Kim, J. (1993). Supervenience and Mind: Selected Philosophical Essays (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press).
Kim, J. (1990). “Supervenience as a Philosophical Concept,” Metaphilosophy 21: 1-27.
Kim, J. (1989). “The Myth of Nonreductive Physicalism,” Proceedings and Addresses of the American Philosophical Association 63: 31-47.
Kim, J. (1987). “‘Strong’ and ‘Global’ Supervenience Revisited,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 48: 315-326.
Kim, J. (1984). “Concepts of Supervenience,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 45: 153-176.
Kirk, R. (2006). “Physicalism and Strict Implication,” Synthese 151: 523-536.
Kirk, R. (1996). “Strict Implication, Supervenience, and Physicalism,” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 74: 244-256.
Lewis, D. (1986). The Plurality of Worlds (Oxford: Blackwell).
Lewis, D. (1983). “New Work for a Theory of Universals,” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 61: 343-377.
McLaughlin, B. and K. Bennett (2005). “Supervenience,” in E. N. Zalta (ed.), The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
McLaughlin, B. (1995). “Varieties of Supervenience,” in E. Savellos and U. D. Yakrin (eds.), Supervenience: New Essays (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press): 16-59.
McLaughlin, B. (1992). “The Rise and Fall of British Emergentism,” in A. Beckermann, H. Flohr, and J. Kim (eds.), Emergence or Reduction? Essays on the Prospects of Nonreductive Physicalism (Berlin: De Gruyter): 49-93.
Melnyk, A. (2006). “Realization and the Formulation of Physicalism,” Philosophical Studies 131: 127-155.
Melnyk, A. (2003). A Physicalist Manifesto (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press).
Melnyk, A. (1996). “Formulating Physicalism: Two Suggestions,” Synthese 105: 381-407.
Moore, G. E. (1922). Philosophical Studies (London: Routledge).
Moreland, J. P. (1998). “Should a Naturalist be a Supervenient Physicalist?,” Metaphilosophy 29: 35-57.
Moser, P. (1992). “Physicalism and Global Supervenience,” The Southern Journal of Philosophy 30: 71-82.
Papineau, D. (1993). Philosophical Naturalism (Oxford: Blackwell).
Paull, C. and T. Sider (1992). “In Defense of Global Supervenience,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 32: 830-45.
Petrie, B. (1987). “Global Supervenience and Reduction,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 48:119-30.
Pettit, P. (1993). “A Definition of Physicalism,” Analysis 53: 213-223.
Place, U. T. (1956). “Is Consciousness a Brain Process?,” The British Journal of Psychology 47: 44-50.
Poland, J. (1994). Physicalism: The Philosophical Foundations (Oxford: Oxford University Press).
Putnam, H. (1975). “The Meaning of Meaning,’ in K. Gunderson (ed.), Language, Mind, and Knowledge, Minnesota Studies in the Philosophy of Science 7:131-193.
Putnam, H. (1973). “Meaning and Reference,” The Journal of Philosophy 70: 699-711.
Rickles, D. (2006). “Supervenience and Determination,” in J. Fieser and B. Dowden (eds.), Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
Shoemaker, S. (1998). “Causal and Metaphysical Necessity,” Pacific Philosophical Quarterly 79: 59-77.
Shoemaker, S. (1980). “Causality and Properties,” in P. van Inwagen (ed.), Time and Cause (Dordrecht: D. Reidel): 109-135.
Shrader, W. (2008). “On the Relevance of Supervenience Theses to Physicalism,” Acta Analytica 23: 257-271.
Smart, J. J. C. (1959). “Sensation and Brain Processes,” The Philosophical Review 68: 141-156.
Stalnaker, R. (1996). “Varieties of Supervenience,” Philosophical Perspectives 10: 221-41.
Steward, H. (1996). “Papineau’s Physicalism,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 56: 667-672.
Van Cleve, J. (1990). “Mind-Dust or Magic?: Panpsychism versus Emergence,” Philosophical Perspectives 4: 215-226.
Witmer, D. G. (1999). “Supervenience Physicalism and the Problem of Extras,” The Southern Journal of Philosophy 37: 315-331.
Wilson, J. (2005). “Supervenience-based Formulations of Physicalism,” Nous 39: 426-459.
Yoshimi, J. (2007). “Supervenience, Determination, and Dependence,” Pacific Philosophical Quarterly 88: 114-133.

Author Information

Robert Francescotti
Email: rfrances@mail.sdsu.edu
San Diego State University
U. S. A.

Aquinas: Metaphysics

Metaphysics is taken by Thomas Aquinas to be the study of being qua being, that is, a study of the most fundamental aspects of being that constitute a being and without which it could not be. Aquinas’s metaphysical thought follows a modified but general Aristotelian view. Primarily, for Aquinas, a thing cannot be unless it possesses an act of being, and the thing that possesses an act of being is thereby rendered an essence/existence composite. If an essence has an act of being, the act of being is limited by that essence whose act it is. The essence in itself is the definition of a thing; and the paradigm instances of essence/existence composites are material substances (though not all substances are material for Aquinas; for example, God is not). A material substance (say, a cat or a tree) is a composite of matter and form, and it is this composite of matter and form that is primarily said to exist. In other words, the matter/form composite is predicated neither of, nor in, anything else and is the primary referent of being; all other things are said of it. The details of this very rich metaphysical landscape are described below.

The Nature of Metaphysics
Essence and Existence
Participation
Substance and Accident
Matter and Form
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources
2. General Studies

1. The Nature of Metaphysics

Saint Thomas, that is, Aquinas, clarifies the nature of metaphysics through ascertaining its particular subject-matter, its field of investigation. In order to ascertain the subject-matter of any particular science, Thomas distinguishes between the different intellectual operations that we use when engaged in some particular scientific endeavor. Broadly speaking, these fall into two categories: the speculative and the practical. Concerning some sciences, the intellect is merely speculative by contemplating the truth of some particular subject-matter; while concerning other sciences, the intellect is practical, by ascertaining the truth and seeking to apply. There are thus correspondingly two distinct classes of science: speculative science and practical science. Speculative sciences are those that contemplate truth whereas practical sciences are those that apply truth for some practical purpose. The sciences are then further distinguished through differentiating their various subject-matters.

Insofar as the speculative sciences merely contemplate truth but do not apply it for some practical purpose, the subject-matter of the speculative sciences is that which can be understood to some extent. Working within the Aristotelian tradition, Thomas holds that something is understood when it is separated from matter and is necessary to thing in some respect. For instance, when we understand the nature of a tree, what we understand is not primarily the matter that goes to constitute the tree in question, but what it is to be a tree, or the structuring principle of the matter that so organizes it and specifies it as a tree rather than a plant. Furthermore, assuming our understanding is correct, when we understand a thing to be a tree, we do not understand it to be a dog, or a horse, or a cat. Thus, in our understanding of a tree, we understand that which is necessary for the tree to be a tree, and not of anything that is not a tree. Hence, our understanding of a thing is separated from its matter and is necessary to it in some respect. Now, what is in motion is not necessary, since what is in motion can change. Thus, the degree to which we have understood something is conditional upon the degree to which it is separated from matter and motion. It follows then that speculative objects, the subject-matter of the speculative-sciences, insofar as they are what are understood, will be separated from matter and motion to some degree. Any distinctions that obtain amongst speculative objects will in turn signify distinctions amongst the sciences that consider those objects; and we can find distinctions amongst speculative objects based upon their disposition towards matter and motion.

There are three divisions that can apply to speculative objects, thereby permitting us to differentiate the sciences that consider such objects: (i) there is a class of speculative objects that are dependent on matter and motion both for their being and for their being understood, for instance, human beings cannot be without matter, and they cannot be understood without their constituent matter (flesh and bones); (ii) there is a class of speculative objects that depend on matter and motion for their being, but not for their being understood, for instance, we can understand lines, numbers, and points without thereby understanding the matter in which they are found, yet such things cannot be without matter; (iii) there is a class of speculative objects that depend on matter and motion neither for their being nor for their being understood.

Given these three classes of speculative objects, the speculative sciences that consider them can be enumerated accordingly: (i) physical science considers those things that depend on matter and motion both for their being and for their being understood; (ii) mathematics considers those things that depend on matter and motion for their being but not for their being understood; (iii) metaphysics or theology deals with those things that depend on matter and motion neither for their being nor for their being understood. Before going on to consider the subject-matter of metaphysics in a little more detail, it is important to point out that Thomas takes this division of the speculative sciences as exhaustive. For Thomas, there could be no fourth speculative science; the reason for this is that the subject-matter of such a science would have to be those things that depend on matter and motion for their being understood but not for their being, for all other combinations have been exhausted. Now, if a thing depends on matter and motion for its being understood but not for its being, then matter and motion would be put into its definition, which defines a thing as it exists. But if a thing’s existence is so defined as to include matter and motion, then it follows that it depends on matter and motion for its being; for it cannot be understood to be without matter and motion. Hence, all things that include matter and motion in their definitions are dependent on matter and motion for their being, but not all things that depend on matter and motion for their being depend on matter and motion for their being understood. There could be no fourth speculative science since there is no fourth class of speculative objects depending on matter and motion for their being understood but not for their being. Thomas thus sees this threefold division of the speculative sciences as an exhaustive one.

The third class of speculative objects comprises the objects of metaphysics or theology. Now Thomas does not equate these two disciplines, but goes on to distinguish between the proper subject-matter of metaphysics and the proper subject-matter of theology. Recall that this third class of speculative objects comprises those things depending on matter and motion neither for their being nor for their being understood. Such things are thus immaterial things; however, Thomas here draws a distinction. There are things that are immaterial insofar as they are in themselves complete immaterial substances; God and the angels would be examples of such things. To give the latter a title, let them be called positively immaterial. On the other hand there are things that are immaterial insofar as they simply do not depend on matter and motion, but can nevertheless be sometimes said to be found therein. In other words, things of the latter category are neutral with respect to being found in matter and motion, and hence they are neutrally immaterial. St Thomas’s examples of the latter are: being, substance, potency, form, act, one and many; such things can apply equally to material things (such as humans, dogs, cats, mice) and, to some extent, to positively immaterial things. Thus, the neutrally immaterial seem to signify certain aspects or modes of being that can apply equally to material and to immaterial things. The question then arises: what is the proper subject-matter of metaphysics: the positively immaterial or the neutrally immaterial?

According to Thomas, unaided human reason cannot have direct knowledge of the positively immaterial; this is because such things (God and angels) outstrip the human intellect’s capacity to know. Nevertheless, direct knowledge of the positively immaterial is possible, but this will not be on the basis of unaided human reason; it will require that the positively immaterial reveal themselves to us in some way, in which case direct knowledge of the positively immaterial will be dependent on some sort of revelation. As it is a purely rational science, not dependent on or presupposing the truths of revelation, metaphysics will be a study of the neutrally immaterial aspects of things, that is, a study of those modes of being that apply to all beings, whether they are material or immaterial. Such a study will be in accord with the Aristotelian conception of metaphysics as a study of being qua being, insofar as the neutrally immaterial apply to all beings and are not restricted to a certain class of beings. However, Thomas does not adopt the Aristotelian phrase (being qua being) as the subject-matter of metaphysics, he offers his own term. According to Thomas, ens commune (common being) is the proper subject-matter of metaphysics. Through an investigation of ens commune, an investigation into the aspects of being common to all beings, the metaphysician may indeed come to a knowledge of the causes of being and might thereby be led to the affirmation of divine being, but this is only at the end of the metaphysical inquiry, not at the beginning. Thus, metaphysics for Aquinas is a study of ens commune where this is understood as the common aspects of being without which a thing could not be; it does not presuppose the existence of divine being, and may not even be led to an affirmation of divine being (though Thomas of course offers several highly complex metaphysical arguments for the existence of divine being, but this should not be taken to be essential to the starting point of Thomistic metaphysics).

Metaphysics then is a study of the certain aspects common to all beings; and it is the task of the metaphysician to uncover the aspects of being that are indeed common and without which a thing could not be. There are certain aspects of being that are common insofar as they are generally applicable to all beings, and these are essence and existence; all beings exist and have an essence, hence metaphysics will be primarily concerned with the nature of essence and existence and their relationship to each other. Having completed an investigation into essence and existence, the metaphysician must investigate the aspects of being that are common to particular instances of being; and this will be a study of (i) the composition of substance and accident, and (ii) the composition of matter and form. The format of Thomistic metaphysics then takes a somewhat dyadic structure of descending generality: (i) essence and existence, (ii) substance and accident, (iii) matter and form. The format of the remainder of this article will be an investigation into these dyadic structures.

2. Essence and Existence

A general notion of essence is the following: essence is the definable nature of the thing that exists. Quite generally then, the essence of a thing is signified by its definition. The immediate question then is how the essence of a thing relates to its existence. In finite entities, essence is that which has existence, but it is not existence; this is a crude articulation of Thomas’s most fundamental metaphysical teaching: that essence and existence are distinct in finite entities. A consideration then of essence and existence in Thomas’s metaphysical thought will thus be a consideration of his fundamental teaching that essence and existence are distinct.

The most famous, and to a certain degree the most controversial, instance wherein Thomas argues for a distinction between a thing’s essence and its existence is in De Ente et Essentia [On Being and Essence] Chapter Four. The context is a discussion of immaterial substances and whether or not they are composed of matter. In that passage, Thomas is concerned with a popular medieval discussion known as universal hylemorphism. St Bonaventure, Thomas’s contemporary, had held that insofar as creatures are in potency in some respect, they must be material in some respect, since on the Aristotelian account, matter is the principle of potency in a thing. Thus, creatures, even immaterial creatures, must be material in some respect, even if this materiality is nothing like our corporeal materiality. Thomas takes up this issue in De Ente Chapter 4, pointing out that the Jewish thinker Avicebron seems to have been the author of this position.

Thomas takes the notion of universal hylemorphism to be absurd. Not only does it conflict with the common sayings of the philosophers, but also it is precisely as separated from matter and all material conditions that we deem separate (immaterial) substances separate, in which case they cannot be composed of matter. But if such substances cannot be composed of matter, what accounts for their potentiality? Such substances are not God, they are not pure act, they are in potentiality in some respect. So, if they are not material, then how are they in potency? Thomas is thus led to hold that they have an element of potentiality, but this is not the potency supplied by matter; rather, immaterial substances are composed of essence and existence, and it is the essence of the thing, standing in potency to a distinct act of existence, that accounts for the potentiality of creatures and thereby distinguishes them from God, who is not so composed. Thomas’s argumentation for the distinction between essence and existence unfolds on three stages and for each stage there has been at least one commentator who has held that Thomas both intended and established the real distinction therein.

In the first stage Thomas argues as follows. Whatever does not enter into the understanding of any essence is composed with that essence from without; for we cannot understand an essence without understanding the parts of that essence. But we can understand the essence of something without knowing anything about its existence; for instance, one can understand the essence of a man or a phoenix without thereby understanding the existence of either. Hence, essence and existence are distinct.

This little paragraph has generated considerable controversy, insofar as it is unclear what sort of distinction Thomas intends to establish at this stage. Is it merely a logical distinction whereby it is one thing to understand the essence of a thing and another to understand its existence? On this account, essence and existence could well be identical in the thing yet distinct in our understanding thereof (just as ‘Morning star’ and ‘Evening star’ are distinct in our conceptual expressions of the planet Venus, yet both are identical with Venus). On the other hand, does Thomas attempt to establish a real distinction whereby essence and existence are not only distinct in our understanding, but also in the thing itself? Commentators who hold that this stage only establishes a logical distinction focus on the fact that Thomas is here concerned only with our understanding of essence and not with actual (real) things; such commentators include Joseph Owens and John Wippel. Commentators who hold that this stage establishes a real distinction focus on the distinction between the act of understanding a thing’s essence and the act of knowing its existence, and they argue that a distinction in cognitional acts points to a distinction in reality; such commentators include Walter Patt, Anthony Kenny, and Steven Long.

In the second stage of argumentation, Thomas claims that if there were a being whose essence is its existence, there could only be one such being, in all else essence and existence would differ. This is clear when we consider how things can be multiplied. A thing can be multiplied in one of three ways: (i) as a genus is multiplied into its species through the addition of some difference, for instance the genus ‘animal’ is multiplied into the species ‘human’ through the addition of ‘rational’; (ii) as a species is multiplied into its individuals through being composed with matter, for instance the species ‘human’ is multiplied into various humans through being received in diverse clumps of matter; (iii) as a thing is absolute and shared in by many particular things, for instance if there were some absolute fire from which all other fires were derived. Thomas claims that a being whose essence is its existence could not be multiplied in either of the first two ways (he does not consider the third way, presumably because in that case the thing that is received or participated in is not itself multiplied; the individuals are multiplied and they simply share in some single absolute reality). A being whose essence is its existence could not be multiplied (i) through the addition of some difference, for then its essence would not be its existence but its existence plus some difference, nor could it be multiplied (ii) through being received in matter, for then it would not be subsistent, but it must be subsistent if it exists in virtue of what it is. Overall then, if there were a being whose essence is its existence, it would be unique, there could only be one such being, in all else essence and existence are distinct.

Notice that Thomas has once again concluded that essence and existence are distinct. John Wippel takes this to be the decisive stage in establishing that essence and existence are really distinct. He argues that insofar as it is impossible for there to be more than one being whose essence is its existence, there could not be in reality many such beings, in which case if we grant that there are multiple beings in reality, such beings are composed of essence and existence. On the other hand, Joseph Owens has charged Wippel with an ontological move and claims that Wippel is arguing from some positive conceptual content, to the actuality of that content in reality. Owens argues that we cannot establish the real distinction until we have established that there is something whose essence is its existence. Given the existence of a being whose essence is its existence, we can contrast its existence with the existence of finite things, and conclude that the latter are composites of essence and existence; and so Owens sees the real distinction as established at stage three of Thomas’s argumentation: the proof that there actually is a being whose essence is its existence.

Thomas begins stage three with the premise that whatever belongs to a thing belongs to it either through its intrinsic principles, its essence, or from some extrinsic principle. A thing cannot be the cause of its own existence, for then it would have to precede itself in existence, which is absurd. Everything then whose essence is distinct from its existence must be caused to be by another. Now, what is caused to be by another is led back to what exists in itself (per se). There must be a cause then for the existence of things, and this because it is pure existence (esse tantum); otherwise an infinite regress of causes would ensue.

It is here that Owens believes that Thomas establishes the real distinction; since Thomas establishes (to his own satisfaction) that there exists a being whose essence is its existence. Consequently, we can contrast the existence of such a being with the existence of finite entities and observe that in the latter existence is received as from an efficient cause whereas in the former it is not. Thus, essence and existence are really distinct. However, it is important to note that on this interpretation, the real distinction could not enter into the argument for the existence of a being whose essence is its existence; for, on Owens’s account, such argumentation is taken to establish the real distinction. If it can be shown then that Thomas’s argumentation for the existence of a being whose essence is its existence does presuppose the real distinction, then Owens’s views as to the stage at which the real distinction is established would be considerably undermined.

Having established (at some stage) that essence and existence are distinct and that there exists a being whose essence is its existence, Thomas goes on to conclude that in immaterial substances, essence is related to existence as potency to act. The latter follows insofar as what receives existence stands in potency to the existence that it receives. But all things receive existence from the being whose essence is its existence, in which case the existence that any one finite thing possesses is an act of existence that actuates a corresponding potency: the essence. Thomas has thus shown that immaterial substances do indeed have an element of potency, but this need not be a material potency.

Notice that here Thomas correlates essence and existence as potency and act only after he has concluded to the existence of a being whose essence is its existence (God). One wonders then whether or not essence and existence can be related as potency and act only on the presupposition of the existence of God. Regardless of his preferred method in the De Ente Chapter 4, Thomas could very well have focussed on the efficiently caused character of existence in finite entities (as he does in the opening lines of the argument for the existence of God), and argued that insofar as existence is efficiently caused (whether or not this is from God), existence stands to that in which it inheres as act to potency, in which case the essence that possesses existence stands in potency to that act of existence. Therefore, Thomas need not presuppose the existence of God in order to hold that essence and existence are related as potency and act; all he need presuppose is (i) that essence and existence are distinct and (ii) that existence is efficiently caused in the essence/existence composite.

3. Participation

Essence/existence composites merely have existence; whatever an essence/existence composite is, it is not its existence. Insofar as essence/existence composites merely have, but are not, existence, they participate in existence in order to exist. This is a second of Thomas’s fundamental metaphysical teachings: whatever does not essentially exist, merely participates in existence. Insofar as no essence/existence composite essentially exists, all essence/existence composites merely participate in existence. More specifically, the act of existence that each and every essence/existence composite possesses is participated in by the essence that exists.

As a definition of participation, Thomas claims that to participate is to take a part (in) (partem capere) something. Following this definition, Thomas goes on to explain how one thing can be said to take a part in and thereby participate in another; this can happen in three ways.

Firstly, when something receives in a particular fashion what pertains universally to another, it is said to participate in that other; for example, a species (‘man’) is said to participate in its genus (‘animal’) and an individual (Socrates) is said to participate in its species (‘man’) because they (the species and the individual) do not possess the intelligible structure of that in which they participate according to its full universality.

Secondly, a subject is said to participate in the accidents that it has (for instance, a man is a certain colour, and thereby participates in the colour of which he is), and matter is said to participate in the formal structure that it has (for instance, the matter of a statue participates in the shape of that statue in order to be the statue in question).

Thirdly, an effect can be said to participate in its cause, especially when the effect is not equal to the power of that cause. The effect particularises and determines the scope of the cause; for the effect acts as the determinate recipient of the power of the cause. The effect receives from its cause only that which is necessary for the production of the effect. It is in this way that a cause is participated in by its effect.

In all of the foregoing modes of participation, to participate is to limit that which is participated in some respect. This follows from the original etymological definition of participation, that to participate is to take a part (in); for if to participate is merely to take a part in something, the participant will not possess the nature of the thing in which it participates in any total fashion, but only in partial fashion. What then can we conclude about the participation framework that governs essence and existence?

Essences exist, but they do not exist essentially, they participate in their acts of existence. Insofar as an essence participates in its act of existence, the essence limits that act of existence to the nature of the essence whose act it is; for the essence merely has existence, it is not existence, in which case its possession of existence will be in accord with the nature of the essence. The act of existence is thus limited and thereby individuated to the essence whose act it is. As a concrete application of this, consider the following. George Bush’s existence is not Tony Blair’s existence; when George Bush came into existence, Tony Blair did not come into existence, and when George Bush ceases to exist, Tony Blair will, in all likelihood, not cease to exist. George Bush’s existence is not indexed to the existence of Tony Blair, in which case the existence of either George Bush or Tony Blair is not identical to the other. The act of existence then is individuated to the essence whose act it is, and this because the essence merely participates in, and thereby limits, the act of existence that it possesses.

4. Substance and Accident

The next fundamental metaphysical category is that of substance. According to Aquinas, substances are what are primarily said to exist, and so substances are what have existence but yet are not identical with existence. Aquinas’s ontology then is comprised primarily of substances, and all change is either a change of one substance into another substance, or a modification of an already existing substance. Given that essence is that which is said to possess existence, but is not identical to existence, substances are essence/existence composites; their existence is not guaranteed by what they are. They simply have existence as limited by their essence.

Let us begin with a logical definition of substance, as this will give us an indication of its metaphysical nature. Logically speaking, a substance is what is predicated neither of nor in anything else. This captures the fundamental notion that substances are basic, and everything else is predicated either of or in them. Now, if we transpose this logical definition of substance to the realm of metaphysics, where existence is taken into consideration, we can say that a substance is that whose nature it is to exist not in some subject or as a part of anything else, but what exists in itself. Thus, a substance is a properly basic entity, existing per se (though of course depending on an external cause for its existence), and the paradigm instances of which are the medium sized objects that we see around us: horses, cats, trees and humans.

On the other hand there are accidents. Accidents are what accrue to substances and modify substances in some way. Logically speaking, accidents are predicated of or in some substance; metaphysically speaking, accidents cannot exist in themselves but only as part of some substance. As their name suggests, accidents are incidental to the thing, and they can come and go without the thing losing its identity; whereas a thing cannot cease to be the substance that it is without losing its identity.

Accidents only exist as part of some substance. It follows then that we cannot have un-exemplified properties as if they were substances in themselves. Properties are always exemplified by some substance, whereas substance itself is un-exemplifiable. For example, brown is always predicated of something, we say that x is brown, in which case brown is an accident. However, brown is never found to be in itself, it is always exemplified by something of which it is said.

Within Aquinas’s metaphysical framework, substances can be both material (cats, dogs, humans) and immaterial (angels), but as noted above, the paradigm instances of substances are material substances, and the latter are composites of matter and form; a material substance is neither its matter alone nor its form alone, since matter and form are always said to be of some individual and never in themselves. It follows then that material substances have parts, and the immediate question arises as to whether or not the parts of substances are themselves substances. In order to address this issue, we must ask two questions: (i) while they are parts of a substance, are such parts themselves substances? and (ii) are the parts of a substance themselves things that can exist without the substance of which they are parts?

Concerning (i) we must say that whilst they are parts of a substance such parts cannot be substances; this is so given the definition of substance outlined above: that whose nature it is to exist not in some subject. Given that the parts of a substance are in fact parts of a substance, it is their nature to exist in some subject of which they are a part. Consequently, the parts of a substance cannot themselves be substances.

Concerning (ii) the case is somewhat different, now we must consider whether or not the parts of a substance can exist without the substance of which they are parts, that is, after the dissolution of the substance of which they are parts do the parts become substances in themselves? The parts of a substance receive their identity through being the parts of the substance whose parts they are. Thus, the flesh and bone of a human are flesh and bone precisely because they are parts of a human. When the human dies, the flesh and bone are no longer flesh and bone (except equivocally speaking) because they are no longer parts of a human substance; rather, the flesh and bone cease to function as flesh and bone and begin to decompose, in which case they are not themselves substances. However, on Aquinas’s view, the elements out of which a substance is made can indeed subsist beyond the dissolution of the substance. Thus, whilst the elements are parts of the substance, they are not, as parts of a substance, substances in themselves, but when the substance dissolves, the elements will remain as independent substances in their own right. Thus, in the case of the dissolution of the human being, whilst the flesh and bone no longer remain but decompose, the elements that played a role in the formation of the substance remain. In more contemporary terms we could say that before they go to make up the bodily substances we see in the world, atoms are substances in themselves, but when united in a certain form they go to make cats, dogs, humans, and cease to be independent substances in themselves. When the cat or dog or human perishes, its flesh and bones perish with it, but its atoms regain their substantial nature and they remain as substances in themselves. So, a substance can have its parts, and for as long as those parts are parts of a substance, those parts are not substances in themselves, but when the substance decomposes, those parts can be considered as substances in themselves so long as they are capable of subsisting in themselves.

5. Matter and Form

A very crude definition of matter would be that it is the ‘stuff’ out of which a thing is made, whereas form is signified by the organisation that the matter takes. A common example used by Aquinas and his contemporaries for explaining matter and form was that of a statue. Consider a marble statue. The marble is the matter of the statue whereas the shape signifies the form of the statue. The marble is the ‘stuff’ out of which the statue is made whereas the shape signifies the form that the artist decided to give to the statue. On a more metaphysical level, form is the principle whereby the matter has the particular structure that it has, and matter is simply that which stands to be structured in a certain way. It follows from this initial account that matter is a principle of potency in a thing; since if the matter is that which stands to be structured in a certain way, matter can be potentially an indefinite number of forms. Form on the other hand is not potentially one thing or another; form as form is the kind of thing that it is and no other.

On Aquinas’s account, there are certain levels of matter/form composition. On one level we can think of the matter of a statue as being the marble whereas we can think of the shape of the statue as signifying the form. But on a different level with can think of the marble as signifying the form and something more fundamental being the matter. For instance, before the marble was formed into the statue by the sculptor, it was a block of marble, already with a certain form that made it ‘marble’. At this level, the marble cannot be the matter of the thing, since its being marble and not, say, granite, is its form. Thus, there is a more fundamental level of materiality that admits of being formed in such a way that the end product is marble or granite, and at a higher level, this formed matter stands as matter for the artist when constructing the statue.

If we think of matter as without any form, we come to the notion of prime matter, and this is a type of matter that is totally unformed, pure materiality itself. Prime matter is the ultimate subject of form, and in itself indefinable; we can only understand prime matter through thinking of matter as wholly devoid of form. As wholly devoid of form prime matter is neither a substance nor any of the other categories of being; prime matter, as pure potency, cannot in fact express any concrete mode of being, since as pure potency is does not exist except as potency. Thus, prime matter is not a thing actually existing, since it has no principle of act rendering it actually existing.

Matter can be considered in two senses: (i) as designated and (ii) as undesignated. Designated matter is the type of matter to which one can point and of which one can make use. It is the matter that we see around us. Undesignated matter is a type of matter that we simply consider through the use of our reason; it is the abstracted notion of matter. For instance, the actual flesh and bones that make up an individual man are instances of designated matter, whereas the notions of ‘flesh’ and ‘bones’ are abstracted notions of certain types of matter and these are taken to enter into the definition of ‘man’ as such. Designated matter is what individuates some form. As noted, the form of a thing is the principle of its material organisation. A thing’s form then can apply to many different things insofar as those things are all organised in the same way. The form then can be said to be universal, since it remains the same but is predicated over different things. As signifying the actual matter that is organised in the thing, designated matter individuates the form to ‘this’ or ‘that’ particular thing, thereby ensuring individuals (Socrates, Plato, Aristotle) of the same form (man).

Given that form is the principle of organisation of a thing’s matter, or the thing’s intelligible nature, form can be of two kinds. On the one hand, form can be substantial, organising the matter into the kind of thing that the substance is. On the other hand, form can be accidental, organising some part of an already constituted substance. We can come to a greater understanding of substantial and accidental form if we consider their relation to matter. Substantial form always informs prime matter and in doing so it brings a new substance into existence; accidental form simply informs an already existing substance (an already existing composite of substantial form and prime matter), and in doing so it simply modifies some substance. Given that substantial form always informs prime matter, there can be only one substantial form of a thing; for if substantial form informs prime matter, any other form that may accrue to a thing is posterior to it and simply informs an already constituted substance, which is the role of accidental form. Thus, there can only be one substantial form of a thing.

As stated above, essence is signified by the definition of a thing; essence is the definable nature of the thing that exists. A thing’s essence then is its definition. It follows that on Thomas’s account the essence of a thing is the composition of its matter and form, where matter here is taken as undesignated matter. Contrary to contemporary theories of essence, Aquinas does not, strictly speaking, take essence to be what is essential to the thing in question, where the latter is determined by a thing’s possessing some property or set of properties in all possible worlds. In the latter context, the essence of a thing comprises its essential properties, properties that are true of it in all possible worlds; but this is surely not Aquinas’s view. For Aquinas, the essence of a thing is not the conglomeration of those properties that it would possess in all possible worlds, but the composition of matter and form. On a possible-worlds view of essence, the essence of a thing could not signify the matter/form composite as it is in this actual world, since such a composite could be different in some possible world and therefore not uniform across all possible worlds. Thus, Aquinas does not adopt a possible-worlds view of essence; he envisages the essence of a thing as the definition or quiddity of the thing existing in this world, not as it would exist in all possible worlds.

6. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

St Thomas Aquinas, Summa Theologiae, trans. Fathers of the English Dominican Province (1948), U.S.A: Christian Classics.
- Aquinas’s philosophical and theological masterpiece; Part I (Prima Pars) is the most important for Thomas’s metaphysical thought.
St Thomas Aquinas, The Divisions and Methods of the Sciences: Questions V and VI of his Commentary on the De Trinitate of Boethius, trans. Armand Maurer (1953) Toronto: Pontifical Institute of Medieval Studies.
- A detailed consideration by Thomas of the divisions and methods of the sciences.
St Thomas Aquinas, On Being and Essence, trans. Armand Maurer (1968), Toronto: Pontifical Institute Medieval Studies.
- An excellent summary from Aquinas himself of his metaphysical views.
St Thomas Aquinas, Summa Contra Gentiles, trans. A.C Pegis (1975), Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press.
- One of Aquinas’s great Summae; books I and II are most important for Thomas’s metaphysical thought.
St Thomas Aquinas, Commentary on Aristotle’s Metaphysics, trans. John P. Rowan (1995), U.S.A: Dumb Ox Books.
- A direct commentary on the Metaphysics of Aristotle.
St Thomas Aquinas, Aquinas on matter and form and the elements: a translation and interpretation of the De principiis naturae and the De mixtione elementorum of St. Thomas Aquinas, trans. Joseph Bobik (1998), Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press.
- A translation of and commentary on Aqiunas’s works on ‘matter and form and the elements’.

b. General Studies

Clarke, W.N., Explorations in Metaphysics — Being, God, Person (1994), Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press.
Clarke, W.N., The One and the Many — A Contemporary Thomistic Metaphysics (2001), Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press.
Copleston, F., Aquinas (1955), London: Penguin.
Davies, B., The Thought of Thomas Aquinas (1993), Oxford: Clarendon Paperbacks.
Fabro, C., La Nozione Metafisica di Partecipazione secondo S. Tommaso d’Aquino (1950), Turin: Società Editrice Internazionale.
Fabro, C., Participation et causalité selon S. Thomas d’Aquin (1961), Louvain: Publications Universaitaires.
- Both works by Fabro were groundbreaking for their uncovering the Platonic influences in Aquinas’s thought.
de Finance, J., Être et agir dans la philosophie de Saint Thomas (1960), Rome: Librairie Éditrice de l’Université Grégorienne.
Geiger, L-B., La participation dans la philosophie de s. Thomas d’Aquin (1953), Paris: Librairie Philosophique J. Vrin.
- As with Fabro’s work, Geiger’s too uncovers the Platonic influences in Aquinas’s thought.
Kenny, A., Aquinas on Being (2003), Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Klima, G., ‘Contemporary “Essentialism” vs. Aristotelian Essentialism’, in John Haldane, ed., Mind Metaphysics, and Value in the Thomistic and Analytical Traditions (2002), Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press.
Kretzman, N., & Stump, E. eds. The Cambridge Companion to Aquinas (1993), Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Long, S., ‘On the Natural Knowledge of the Real Distinction’, Nova et Vetera (2003), 1:1.
Long, S., ‘Aquinas on Being and Logicism’, New Blackfriars (2005), 86.
Owens, J., ‘A Note on the Approach to Thomistic Metaphysics’, The New Scholasticism (1954), 28:4.
Owens, J., ‘Quiddity and the Real Distinction in St Thomas Aquinas’, Mediaeval Studies (1965), 27.
Owens, J., The Doctrine of Being in the Aristotelian Metaphysics (1978), Toronto: Pontifical Institute of Medieval Studies.
Owens, J., St Thomas Aquinas on the Existence of God — The Collected Papers of Joseph Owens ed. Catan, John. R. (1980), Albany: State University of New York Press.
Owens, J., ‘Stages and Distinction in De Ente’, The Thomist, (1981), 45.
Owens, J., An Elementary Christian Metaphysics (1985), Houston, Texas: Bruce Publishing Company.
Owens, J., An Interpretation of Existence (1985), Texas: Center for Thomistic Studies — University of St Thomas.
Owens, J., ‘Aquinas’s Distinction at De Ente et Essentia 4.119 — 123’, Mediaeval Studies (1986), 48.
Patt, W. ‘Aquinas’s Real Distinction and some Interpretations’, The New Scholasticism (1988), 62:1.
Stump, E., Aquinas (2003), London-New York: Routledge.
- Part I, Chapter I, offers a very good survey of Aquinas’s metaphysics, but leaves out details of his theory of essence/existence composition. Pp. 36 – 44 are particularly illuminating on matter and form, substance and accident.
Torrell, J.-P., Saint Thomas Aquinas: The Person and His Work, trans. Robert Royal (1996), Washington: The Catholic University of America Press.
- This is the most up-to-date publication on Aquinas’s life and work.
te Velde R. A., Participation and Substantiality in Thomas Aquinas (1995), Leiden-New York-Cologne: E.J. Brill.
Wippel, J., 1979: ‘Aquinas’s Route to the Real Distinction’, The Thomist, 43.
Wippel, J., Metaphysical Themes in Thomas Aquinas (1984), USA: The Catholic University of America Press.
Wippel, J., The Metaphysical Thought of Thomas Aquinas (2000), USA: The Catholic University of America Press.
Wippel, J., Metaphysical Themes in Thomas Aquinas II (2007), USA: The Catholic University of America Press.
- Wippel’s work is generally taken to be essential for scholarly work on Aquinas’s metaphysical thought.

Author Information

Gaven Kerr
Email: gkerr07@qub.ac.uk
Queen’s University Belfast
Northern Ireland

David Hume (1711—1776)

“Hume is our Politics, Hume is our Trade, Hume is our Philosophy, Hume is our Religion, — it wants little but that Hume is even our Taste”. This statement by nineteenth century philosopher James Hutchison Stirling reflects the unique position in intellectual thought held by Scottish philosopher David Hume. Part of Hume’s fame and importance owes to his boldly skeptical approach to a range of philosophical subjects. In epistemology, he questioned common notions of personal identity, and argued that there is no permanent “self” that continues over time. He dismissed standard accounts of causality and argued that our conceptions of cause-effect relations are grounded in habits of thinking, rather than in the perception of causal forces in the external world itself. He defended the skeptical position that human reason is inherently contradictory, and it is only through naturally-instilled beliefs that we can navigate our way through common life. In the philosophy of religion, he argued that it is unreasonable to believe testimonies of alleged miraculous events, and he hints, accordingly, that we should reject religions that are founded on miracle testimonies. Against the common belief of the time that God’s existence could be proven through a design or causal argument, Hume offered compelling criticisms of standard theistic proofs. He also advanced theories on the origin of popular religious beliefs, grounding such notions in human psychology rather than in rational argument or divine revelation. The larger aim of his critique was to disentangle philosophy from religion and thus allow philosophy to pursue its own ends without rational over-extension or psychological corruption. In moral theory, against the common view that God plays an important role in the creation and reinforcement of moral values, he offered one of the first purely secular moral theories, which grounded morality in the pleasing and useful consequences that result from our actions. He introduced the term “utility” into our moral vocabulary, and his theory is the immediate forerunner to the classic utilitarian views of Jeremy Bentham and John Stuart Mill. He is famous for the position that we cannot derive ought from is, the view that statements of moral obligation cannot simply be deduced from statements of fact. Some see Hume as an early proponent of the emotivist metaethical view that moral judgments principally express our feelings. He also made important contributions to aesthetic theory with his view that there is a uniform standard of taste within human nature, in political theory with his critique of social contractarianism, and economic theory with his anti-mercantilist views. As a philosophical historian, he defended the conservative view that British governments are best run through a strong monarchy.

Life
Origin and Association of Ideas
Epistemological Issues
Skepticism
Theory of the Passions
Religious Belief
Moral Theory
Aesthetic, Political, and Economic Theory
History and Philosophy
References and Further Reading

1. Life

David Hume was born in 1711 to a moderately wealthy family from Berwickshire Scotland, near Edinburgh. His background was politically Whiggish and religiously Calvinistic. As a child he faithfully attended the local Church of Scotland, pastored by his uncle. Hume was educated by his widowed mother until he left for the University of Edinburgh at the age of eleven. His letters describe how as a young student he took religion seriously and obediently followed a list of moral guidelines taken from The Whole Duty of Man, a popular Calvinistic devotional.

Leaving the University of Edinburgh around the age of fifteen to pursue his education privately, he was encouraged to consider a career in law, but his interests soon turned to philosophy. During these years of private study he began raising serious questions about religion, as he recounts in the following letter:

Tis not long ago that I burn’d an old Manuscript Book, wrote before I was twenty; which contain’d, Page after Page, the gradual Progress of my Thoughts on that head [i.e. religious belief]. It begun with an anxious Search after Arguments, to confirm the common Opinion: Doubts stole in, dissipated, return’d, were again dissipated, return’d again [To Gilbert Elliot of Minto, March 10, 1751].

Although his manuscript book was destroyed, several pages of his study notes survive from his early twenties. These show a preoccupation with proofs for God’s existence as well as atheism, particularly as he read on these topics in classical Greek and Latin texts and in Pierre Bayle’s skeptical Historical and Critical Dictionary. During these years of private study, some of which were in France, he composed his three-volume Treatise of Human Nature, which was published anonymously in two installments before he was thirty (1739, 1740). The Treatise explores several philosophical topics such as space, time, causality, external objects, the passions, free will, and morality, offering original and often skeptical appraisals of these notions. Book I of the Treatise was unfavorably reviewed in the History of the Works of the Learned with a succession of sarcastic comments. Although scholars today recognized it as a philosophical masterpiece, Hume was disappointed with the minimal interest his book spawned and said that “It fell dead-born from the press, without reaching such distinctions even to excite a murmur among the zealots” (My Own Life).

In 1741 and 1742 Hume published his two-volume Essays, Moral and Political, which were written in a popular style and were more successful than the Treatise. In 1744-1745 he was a candidate for the Chair of Moral Philosophy at the University of Edinburgh. The Edinburgh Town Council was responsible for electing a replacement, and critics opposed Hume by condemning his anti-religious writings. Chief among the critics was clergyman William Wishart (d. 1752), the Principal of the University of Edinburgh. Lists of allegedly dangerous propositions from Hume’s Treatise circulated, presumably penned by Wishart himself. In the face of such strong opposition, the Edinburgh Town Council consulted the Edinburgh ministers. Hoping to win over the clergy, Hume composed a point by point reply to the circulating lists of dangerous propositions, which was published as A Letter from a Gentleman to his Friend in Edinburgh. The clergy were not swayed, 12 of the 15 ministers voted against Hume, and he quickly withdrew his candidacy. In 1745 Hume accepted an invitation from General St Clair to attend him as secretary. He wore the uniform of an officer, and accompanied the general on an expedition against Canada (which ended in an incursion on the coast of France) and to an embassy post in the courts of Vienna and Turin.

Because of the success of his Essays, Hume was convinced that the poor reception of his Treatise was caused by its style rather than by its content. In 1748 he published his Enquiry Concerning Human Understanding, a more popular rendition of portions of Book I of the Treatise. The Enquiry also includes two sections not found in the Treatise: “Of Miracles” and a dialogue titled “Of a Particular Providence and of a Future State.” Each section contains direct attacks on religious belief. In 1751 he published his Enquiry Concerning the Principles of Morals, which recasts parts of Book III of the Treatise in a very different form. The work establishes a system of morality upon utility and human sentiments alone, and without appeal to divine moral commands. By the end of the century Hume was recognized as the founder of the moral theory of utility, and utilitarian political theorist Jeremy Bentham acknowledged Hume’s direct influence upon him. The same year Hume also published his Political Discourses, which drew immediate praise and influenced economic thinkers such as Adam Smith, William Godwin, and Thomas Malthus.

In 1751-1752 Hume sought a philosophy chair at the University of Glasgow, and was again unsuccessful. In 1752 his new employment as librarian of the Advocate’s Library in Edinburgh provided him with the resources to pursue his interest in history. There, he wrote much of his highly successful six-volume History of England (published from 1754 to 1762). The first volume was unfavorably received, partially for its defense of Charles I, and partially for two sections which attack Christianity. In one passage Hume notes that the first Protestant reformers were fanatical or “inflamed with the highest enthusiasm” in their opposition to Roman Catholic domination. In the second passage he labels Roman Catholicism a superstition which “like all other species of superstition. . . rouses the vain fears of unhappy mortals.” The most vocal attack against Hume’s History came from Daniel MacQueen in his 300 page Letters on Mr. Hume’s History. MacQueen scrutinizes the first volume of Hume’s work, exposing all the allegedly “loose and irreligious sneers” Hume makes against Christianity. Ultimately, this negative response led Hume to delete the two controversial passages from succeeding editions of the History.

Around this time Hume also wrote his two most substantial works on religion: The Dialogues Concerning Natural Religion and The Natural History of Religion. The Natural History appeared in 1757, but, on the advice of friends who wished to steer Hume away from religious controversy, the Dialogues remained unpublished until 1779, three years after his death. The Natural History aroused controversy even before it was made public. In 1756 a volume of Hume’s essays titled Five Dissertations was printed and ready for distribution. The essays included (1) “The Natural History of Religion;” (2) “Of the Passions;” (3) “Of Tragedy;” (4) “Of Suicide;” and (5) “Of the Immortality of the Soul.” The latter two essays made direct attacks on common religious doctrines by defending a person’s moral right to commit suicide and by criticizing the idea of life after death. Early copies were passed around, and Hume’s publisher was threatened with prosecution if the book was distributed as it was. The printed copies of Five Dissertations were then physically altered by removing the essays on suicide and immortality, and inserting a new essay “Of the Standard of Taste” in their place. Hume also took this opportunity to alter two particularly offending paragraphs in the Natural History. The essays were then bound with the new title Four Dissertations and distributed in January, 1757.

In the years following Four Dissertations, Hume completed his last major literary work, The History of England, which gave him a reputation as an historian that equaled, if not overshadowed, his reputation as a philosopher. In 1763, at age 50, he was invited to accompany the Earl of Hertford to the embassy in Paris, with a near prospect of being his secretary. He eventually accepted, and remarks at the reception he received in Paris “from men and women of all ranks and stations.” He returned to Edinburgh in 1766, and continued developing relations with the greatest minds of the time. Among these was Jean Jacques Rousseau who in 1766 was ordered out of Switzerland by the government in Berne. Hume offered Rousseau refuge in England and secured him a government pension. In England, Rousseau became suspicious of plots, and publicly charged Hume with conspiring to ruin his character, under the appearance of helping him. Hume published a pamphlet defending his actions and was exonerated. Another secretary appointment took him away from 1767-1768. Returning again to Edinburgh, his remaining years were spent revising and refining his published works, and socializing with friends in Edinburgh’s intellectual circles. In 1770, fellow Scotsman James Beattie published one of the harshest attacks on Hume’s philosophy to ever appear in print, entitled An Essay on the Nature and Immutability of Truth in Opposition to Sophistry and Scepticism. Hume was upset by Beattie’s relentless verbal attacks against him in the work, but the book made Beattie famous and King George III, who admired it, awarded Beattie a pension of £200 per year.

In 1776, at age sixty-five, Hume died from an internal disorder which had plagued him for many months. After his death, his name took on new significance as several of his previously unpublished works appeared. The first was a brief autobiography, My Own Life, but even this unpretentious work aroused controversy. As his friends, Adam Smith and S.J. Pratt, published affectionate eulogies describing how he died with no concern for an afterlife, religious critics responded by condemning this unjustifiable admiration of Hume’s infidelity. Two years later, in 1779, Hume’s Dialogues Concerning Natural Religion appeared. Again, the response was mixed. Admirers of Hume considered it a masterfully written work, while religious critics branded it as dangerous to religion. Finally, in 1782, Hume’s two suppressed essays on suicide and immortality were published. Their reception was almost unanimously negative.

2. Origin and Association of Ideas

Drawing heavily on John Locke’s empiricism, the opening sections of both the Treatise and Enquiry discuss the origins of mental perceptions as laid out in the following categorical scheme:

Perceptions

A. Ideas

1. From memory

2. From imagination

a. From fancy

b. From understanding

(1) Involving relations of ideas

(2) Involving matters of fact

B. Impressions

1. Of sensation (external)

2. Of reflection (internal)

Hume begins by dividing all mental perceptions between ideas (thoughts) and impressions (sensations and feelings), and then makes two central claims about the relation between them. First, advancing what is commonly called Hume’s copy thesis, he argues that all ideas are ultimately copied from impressions. That is, for any idea we select, we can trace the component parts of that idea to some external sensation or internal feeling. This claim places Hume squarely in the empiricist tradition, and he regularly uses this principle as a test for determining the content of an idea under consideration. As proof of the copy thesis, Hume challenges anyone who denies it “to shew a simple impression, that has not a correspondent idea, or a simple idea, that has not a correspondent impression” (Treatise, 1.1.1). Second, advancing what we may call Hume’s liveliness thesis, he argues that ideas and impressions differ only in terms of liveliness. For example, my impression of a tree is simply more vivid than my idea of that tree. One of his early critics, Lord Monboddo (1714–1799) pointed out an important implication of the liveliness thesis, which Hume himself presumably hides. Most modern philosophers held that ideas reside in our spiritual minds, whereas impressions originate in our physical bodies. So, when Hume blurs the distinction between ideas and impressions, he is ultimately denying the spiritual nature of ideas and instead grounding them in our physical nature. In short, all of our mental operations—including our most rational ideas—are physical in nature. As Monboddo writes, “One consequence, which Mr Hume has drawn from this doctrine, is, that, as our Mind can only operate by the organs of the Body, it must perish with the Body” (Ancient Metaphysics, 1782, 2.2.2).

Hume goes on to explain that there are several mental faculties that are responsible for producing our various ideas. He initially divides ideas between those produced by the memory, and those produced by the imagination. The memory is a faculty that conjures up ideas based on experiences as they happened. For example, the memory I have of my drive to the store is a comparatively accurate copy of my previous sense impressions of that experience. The imagination, by contrast, is a faculty that breaks apart and combines ideas, thus forming new ones. Hume uses the familiar example of a golden mountain: this idea is a combination of an idea of gold and an idea of a mountain. As our imagination takes our most basic ideas and leads us to form new ones, it is directed by three principles of association, namely, resemblance, contiguity, and cause and effect. By virtue of resemblance, an illustration or sketch, of a person leads me to an idea of that actual person. The idea of one apartment in a building leads me to think of the apartment contiguous to—or next to—the first. The thought of a scar on my hand leads me to think of a broken piece of glass that caused the scar.

As indicated in the above chart, our more complex ideas of the imagination are further divided between two categories. Some imaginative ideas represent flights of the fancy, such as the idea of a golden mountain; however, other imaginative ideas represent solid reasoning, such as predicting the trajectory of a thrown ball. The fanciful ideas are derived from the faculty of the fancy, and are the source of fantasies, superstitions, and bad philosophy. By contrast, sound ideas are derived from the faculty of the understanding—or reason—and are of two types: (1) involving relations of ideas; or (2) involving matters of fact. A relation of ideas (or relation between ideas) is a mathematical relation that is “discoverable by the mere operation of thought, without dependence on what is anywhere existent in the universe,” such as the mathematical statement “the square of the hypotenuse is equal to the square of the two sides” (Enquiry, 4). By contrast, a matter of fact, for Hume, is any object or circumstance which has physical existence, such as “the sun will rise tomorrow”. This split between relations of ideas and matters of fact is commonly called “Hume’s Fork”, and Hume himself uses it as a radical tool for distinguishing between well-founded ideas of the understanding, and unfounded ideas of the fancy. He dramatically makes this point at the conclusion of his Enquiry:

When we run over libraries, persuaded of these principles, what havoc must we make? If we take in our hand any volume; of divinity or school metaphysics, for instance; let us ask, Does it contain any abstract reasoning concerning quantity or number? No. Does it contain any experimental reasoning concerning matter of fact and existence? No. Commit it then to the flames: For it can contain nothing but sophistry and illusion (Enquiry, 12).

For Hume, when we imaginatively exercise our understanding regarding relations of ideas and matters of fact, our minds are guided by seven philosophical or “reasoning” relations, which are as follows:

Principles of reasoning concerning relations of ideas (involving demonstration): (1) resemblance; (2) contrariety; (3) degrees in quality; and (4) proportions in quantity or number

Principles of reasoning concerning matters of fact (involving judgments of probability): (5) identity; (6) relations in time and place; and (7) causation

Human understanding and reasoning at its best, then, involves ideas that are grounded in the above seven principles.

3. Epistemological Issues

Much of Hume’s epistemology is driven by a consideration of philosophically important issues, such as space and time, cause-effect, external objects, personal identity, and free will. In his analysis of these issues in the Treatise, he repeatedly does three things. First, he skeptically argues that we are unable to gain complete knowledge of some important philosophical notion under consideration. Second, he shows how the understanding gives us a very limited idea of that notion. Third, he explains how some erroneous views of that notion are grounded in the fancy, and he accordingly recommends that we reject those erroneous ideas. We will follow this three-part scheme as we consider Hume’s discussions of various topics.

a. Space

On the topic of space, Hume argues that our proper notions of space are confined to our visual and tactile experiences of the three-dimensional world, and we err if we think of space more abstractly and independently of those visual and tactile experiences. In essence, our proper notion of space is like what Locke calls a “secondary quality” of an object, which is spectator dependent, meaning grounded in the physiology of our perceptual mental processes. Thus, our proper notion of space is not like a “primary quality” that refers to some external state of affairs independent of our perceptual mental process. Following the above three-part scheme, (1) Hume skeptically argues that we have no ideas of infinitely divisible space (Treatise, 1.2.2.2). (2) When accounting for the idea we do have of space, he argues that “the idea of space is convey’d to the mind by two senses, the sight and touch; nor does any thing ever appear extended, that is not either visible or tangible” (Treatise, 1.2.3.15). Further, he argues that these objects—which are either visible or tangible—are composed of finite atoms or corpuscles, which are themselves “endow’d with colour and solidity.” These impressions are then “comprehended” or conceived by the imagination; it is from the structuring of these impressions that we obtain a limited idea of space. (3) In contrast to this idea of space, Hume argues that we frequently presume to have an idea of space that lacks visibility or solidity. He accounts for this erroneous notion in terms of a mistaken association that people naturally make between visual and tactile space (Treatise, 1.2.5.21).

b. Time

Hume’s treatment of our idea of time is like his treatment of the idea of space, in that our proper idea of time is like a secondary quality, grounded in our mental operations, not a primary quality grounded in some external phenomenon beyond our experience. (1) He first maintains that we have no idea of infinitely divisible time (Treatise, 1.2.4.1). (2) He then notes Locke’s point that our minds operate at a range of speeds that are “fix’d by the original nature and constitution of the mind, and beyond which no influence of external objects on the senses is ever able to hasten or retard our thought” (Treatise, 1.2.3.7). The idea of time, then, is not a simple idea derived from a simple impression; instead, it is a copy of impressions as they are perceived by the mind at its fixed speed (Treatise, 1.2.3.10). (3) In contrast to this limited view of time, he argues that we frequently entertain a faulty notion of time that does not involve change or succession. The psychological account of this erroneous view is that we mistake time for the cause of succession instead of seeing it as the effect (Treatise, 1.2.5.29).

c. Necessary Connection between Causes and Effects

According to Hume, the notion of cause-effect is a complex idea that is made up of three more foundational ideas: priority in time, proximity in space, and necessary connection. Concerning priority in time, if I say that event A causes event B, one thing I mean is that A occurs prior to B. If B were to occur before A, then it would be absurd to say that A was the cause of B. Concerning the idea of proximity, if I say that A causes B, then I mean that B is in proximity to, or close to A. For example, if I throw a rock, and at that moment someone’s window in China breaks, I would not conclude that my rock broke a window on the other side of the world. The broken window and the rock must be in proximity with each other. Priority and proximity alone, however, do not make up our entire notion of causality. For example, if I sneeze and the lights go out, I would not conclude that my sneeze was the cause, even though the conditions of priority and proximity were fulfilled. We also believe that there is a necessary connection between cause A and effect B. During the modern period of philosophy, philosophers thought of necessary connection as a power or force connecting two events. When billiard ball A strikes billiard ball B, there is a power that the one event imparts to the other. In keeping with his empiricist copy thesis, that all ideas are copied from impressions, Hume tries to uncover the experiences which give rise to our notions of priority, proximity, and necessary connection. The first two are easy to explain. Priority traces back to our various experiences of time. Proximity traces back to our various experiences of space. But what is the experience which gives us the idea of necessary connection? This notion of necessary connection is the specific focus of Hume’s analysis of cause-effect.

Hume’s view is that our proper idea of necessary connection is like a secondary quality that is formed by the mind, and not, like a primary quality, a feature of the external world. (1) He skeptically argues that we cannot get an idea of necessary connection by observing it through sensory experiences (Treatise, 1.3.14.12 ff.). We have no external sensory impression of causal power when we observe cause-effect relationships; all that we ever see is cause A constantly conjoined with effect B. Neither does it arise from an internal impression, such as when we introspectively reflect on willed bodily motions or willing the creation of thoughts. These internal experiences are too elusive, and nothing in them can give content to our idea of necessary connection. (2) The idea we have of necessary connection arises as follows: we experience a constant conjunction of events A and B— repeated sense experiences where events resembling A are always followed by events resembling B. This produces a habit such that upon any further appearance of A, we expect B to follow. This, in turn, produces an internal feeling of expectation “to pass from an object to the idea of its usual attendant,” which is the impression from which the idea of necessary connection is copied (Treatise, 1.3.14.20). (3) A common but mistaken notion on this topic is that necessity resides within the objects themselves. He explains this mistaken belief by the natural tendency we have to impute subjectively perceived qualities to external things (Treatise, 1.3.14.24).

d. External Objects

Hume’s view on external objects is that the mind is programmed to form some concept of the external world, although this concept or idea is really just a fabrication. (1) Hume’s skeptical claim here is that we have no valid conception of the existence of external things (Treatise, 1.2.6.9). (2) Nevertheless, he argues that we have an unavoidable “vulgar” or common belief in the continued existence of objects, and this idea he accounts for. His explanation is lengthy, but involves the following features. Perceptions of objects are disjointed and have no unity in and of themselves (Treatise, 1.4.2.29). In an effort to organize our perceptions, we first naturally assume that there is no distinction between our perceptions and the objects that are perceived (this is the so-called “vulgar” view of perception). We then conflate all ideas (of perceptions), which put our minds in similar dispositions (Treatise, 1.4.2.33); that is, we associate resembling ideas and attribute identity to their causes. Consequently, we naturally invent the continued and external existence of the objects (or perceptions) that produced these ideas (Treatise, 1.4.2.35). Lastly, we go on to believe in the existence of these objects because of the force of the resemblance between ideas (Treatise, 1.4.2.36). Although this belief is philosophically unjustified, Hume feels he has given an accurate account of how we inevitably arrive at the idea of external existence. (3) In contrast to the previous explanation of this idea, he recommends that we doubt a more sophisticated but erroneous notion of existence—the so-called philosophical view—which distinguishes between perceptions and the external objects that cause perceptions. The psychological motivation for accepting this view is this: our imagination tells us that resembling perceptions have a continued existence, yet our reflection tells us that they are interrupted. Appealing to both forces, we ascribe interruption to perceptions and continuance to objects (Treatise, 1.4.2.52).

e. Personal Identity

Regarding the issue of personal identity, (1) Hume’s skeptical claim is that we have no experience of a simple, individual impression that we can call the self—where the “self” is the totality of a person’s conscious life. He writes, “For my part, when I enter most intimately into what I call myself, I always stumble on some particular perception or other, of heat or cold, light or shade, love or hatred, pain or pleasure. I never can catch myself at any time without a perception, and never can observe anything but the perception” (Treatise, 1.4.6.3). (2) Even though my perceptions are fleeting and I am a bundle of different perceptions, I nevertheless have some idea of personal identity, and that must be accounted for (Treatise, 1.4.6.4). Because of the associative principles, the resemblance or causal connection within the chain of my perceptions gives rise to an idea of myself, and memory extends this idea past my immediate perceptions (Treatise, 1.4.6.18 ff.). (3) A common abuse of the notion of personal identity occurs when the idea of a soul or unchanging substance is added to give us a stronger or more unified concept of the self (Treatise, 1.4.6.6).

f. Free Will

On the issue of free will and determinism—or “liberty” and “necessity” in Hume’s terminology—Hume defends necessity. (1) He first argues that “all actions of the will have particular causes” (Treatise, 2.3.2.8), and so there is no such thing as an uncaused willful action. (2) He then defends the notion of a will that consistently responds to prior motivational causes: “our actions have a constant union with our motives, tempers, and circumstances” (Treatise, 2.3.1.4). These motives produce actions that have the same causal necessity observed in cause-effect relations that we see in external objects, such as when billiard ball A strikes and moves billiard ball B. In the same way, we regularly observe the rock-solid connection between motive A and action B, and we rely on that predictable connection in our normal lives. Suppose that a traveler, in recounting his observation of the odd behavior of natives in a distant country, told us that identical motives led to entirely different actions among these natives. We would not believe the traveler’s report. In business, politics, and military affairs, our leaders expect predicable behavior from us insofar as the same motives within us will always result in us performing the same action. A prisoner who is soon to be executed will assume that the motivations and actions of the prison guards and the executioner are so rigidly fixed that these people will mechanically carry out their duties and perform the execution, with no chance of a change of heart (Treatise, 2.3.1.5 ff.). (3) Lastly, Hume explains why people commonly believe in an uncaused will (Treatise, 2.3.2.1 ff.). One explanation is that people erroneously believe they have a feeling of liberty when performing actions. The reason is that, when we perform actions, we feel a kind of “looseness or indifference” in how they come about, and some people wrongly see this as “an intuitive proof of human liberty” (Treatise, 2.3.2.2).

In the Treatise Hume rejects the notion of liberty completely. While he gives no definition of “liberty” in that work, he argues that the notion is incompatible with necessity, and, at best, “liberty” simply means chance. In the Enquiry, however, he takes a more compatiblist approach. All human actions are caused by specific prior motives, but liberty and necessity are reconcilable when we define liberty as “a power of acting or not acting, according to the determinations of the will” (Enquiry, 8). Nothing in this definition of liberty is in conflict with the notion of necessity.

4. Skepticism

In all of the above discussions on epistemological topics, Hume performs a balancing act between making skeptical attacks (step 1) and offering positive theories based on natural beliefs (step 2). In the conclusion to Book 1, though, he appears to elevate his skepticism to a higher level and exposes the inherent contradictions in even his best philosophical theories. He notes three such contradictions. One centers on what we call induction. Our judgments based on past experience all contain elements of doubt; we are then impelled to make a judgment about that doubt, and since this judgment is also based on past experience it will in turn produce a new doubt. Once again, though, we are impelled to make a judgment about this second doubt, and the cycle continues. He concludes that “no finite object can subsist under a decrease repeated in infinitum.” A second contradiction involves a conflict between two theories of external perception, each of which our natural reasoning process leads us to. One is our natural inclination to believe that we are directly seeing objects as they really are, and the other is the more philosophical view that we only ever see mental images or copies of external objects. The third contradiction involves a conflict between causal reasoning and belief in the continued existence of matter. After listing these contradictions, Hume despairs over the failure of his metaphysical reasoning:

The intense view of these manifold contradictions and imperfections in human reason has so wrought upon me, and heated my brain, that I am ready to reject all belief and reasoning, and can look upon no opinion even as more probable or likely than another [Treatise, 1.4.7.8].

He then pacifies his despair by recognizing that nature forces him to set aside his philosophical speculations and return to the normal activities of common life. He sees, though, that in time he will be drawn back into philosophical speculation in order to attack superstition and educate the world.

Hume’s emphasis on these conceptual contradictions is a unique aspect of his skepticism, and if any part of his philosophy can be designated “Humean skepticism” it is this. However, during the course of his writing the Treatise his view of the nature of these contradictions changed. At first he felt that these contradictions were restricted to theories about the external world, but theories about the mind itself would be free from them, as he explains here:

The essence and composition of external bodies are so obscure, that we must necessarily, in our reasonings, or rather conjectures concerning them, involve ourselves in contradictions and absurdities. But as the perceptions of the mind are perfectly known, and I have us’d all imaginable caution in forming conclusions concerning them, I have always hop’d to keep clear of those contradictions, which have attended every other system [Treatise, 2.2.6.2].

When composing the Appendix to the Treatise a year later, he changed his mind and felt that theories about the mind would also have contradictions:

I had entertained some hopes, that however deficient our theory of the intellectual world might be, it wou’d be free from those contradictions, and absurdities, which seem to attend every explication, that human reason can give of the material world. But upon a more strict review of the section concerning I find myself involv’d in such a labyrinth, that, I must confess, I neither know how to correct my former opinions, nor how to render them consistent. If this be not a good general reason for scepticism, ’tis at least a sufficient one (if I were not already abundantly supplied) for me to entertain a diffidence and modesty in all my decisions [Treatise, Appendix].

Thus, in the Treatise, the skeptical bottom line is that even our best theories about both physical and mental phenomena will be plagued with contradictions. In the concluding section of his Enquiry, Hume again addresses the topic of skepticism, but treats the matter somewhat differently: he rejects extreme skepticism but accepts skepticism in a more moderate form. He associates extreme Pyrrhonian skepticism with blanket attacks on all reasoning about the external world, abstract reasoning about space and time, or causal reasoning about matters of fact. He argues, though, that we must reject such skepticism since “no durable good can ever result from it.” Instead, he recommends a more moderate or Academic skepticism that tones down Pyrrhonism by, first, exercising caution and modesty in our judgments, and, second, by restricting our speculations to abstract reasoning and matters of fact.

5. Theory of the Passions

Like many philosophers of his time, Hume developed a theory of the passions—that is, the emotions—categorizing them and explaining the psychological mechanisms by which they arise in the human mind. His most detailed account is in Book Two of the Treatise. Passions, according to Hume, fall under the category of impressions of reflection (as opposed to impressions of sensation). He opens his discussion with a taxonomy of types of passions, which are outlined here:

Reflective Impressions

1. Calm (reflective pleasures and pains)

2. Violent

a. Direct (desire, aversion, joy, grief, hope, fear)

b. Indirect (love, hate, pride, humility)

He initially divides passions between the calm and the violent. He concedes that this distinction is imprecise, but he explains that people commonly distinguish between types of passions in terms of their degrees of forcefulness. Adding more precision to this common distinction, he maintains that calm passions are emotional feelings of pleasure and pain associated with moral and aesthetic judgments. For example, when I see a person commit a horrible deed, I will experience a feeling of pain. When I view a good work of art, I will experience a feeling of pleasure. In contrast to the calm passions, violent ones constitute the bulk of our emotions, and these divide between direct and indirect passions. For Hume, the key direct passions are desire, aversion, joy, grief, hope, and fear. They are called “direct” because they arise immediately—without complex reflection on our part—whenever we see something good or bad. For example, if I consider an unpleasant thing, such as being burglarized, then I will feel the passion of aversion. He suggests that sometimes these passions are sparked instinctively—for example, by my desire for food when I am hungry. Others, though, are not connected with instinct and are more the result of social conditioning. There is an interesting logic to the six direct passions, which Hume borrowed from a tradition that can be traced to ancient Greek Stoicism. We can diagram the relation between the six with this chart:

When good/bad objects are considered abstractly

Desire (towards good objects)

Aversion (towards evil objects)

When good/bad objects are actually present

Joy (towards good objects)

Grief (towards evil objects)

When good/bad objects are only anticipated

Hope (towards good objects)

Fear (towards evil objects)

Compare, for example, the passions that I will experience regarding winning the lottery vs. having my house burglarized. Suppose that I consider them purely in the abstract—or “consider’d simply” as Hume says (Treatise, 2.3.9.6). I will then desire to win the lottery and have an aversion towards being burglarized. Suppose that both situations are actually before me; I will then experience joy over winning the lottery and grief over being burglarized. Suppose, finally, that I know that at some unknown time in the future I will win the lottery and be burglarized. I will then experience hope regarding the lottery and fear of being burglarized.

Hume devotes most of Book 2 to an analysis of the indirect passions, his unique contribution to theories of the passions. The four principal passions are love, hate, pride, and humility. They are called “indirect” since they are the secondary effects of a previous feeling of pleasure and pain. Suppose, for example, that I paint a picture, which gives me a feeling of pleasure. Since I am the artist, I will then experience an additional feeling of pride. He explains in detail the psychological process that triggers indirect passions such as pride. Specifically, he argues that these passions arise from a double relation between ideas and impressions, which we can illustrate here with the passion of pride:

1. I have an initial idea of some possession, or “subject”, such as my painting, and this idea gives me pleasure.

2. Through the associative principle of resemblance, I then immediately associate this feeling of pleasure with a resembling feeling of pride (this association constitutes the first relation in the double relation).

3. This feeling of pride then causes me to have an idea of myself, as the “object” of pride.

4. Through some associative principle such as causality, I then associate the idea of myself with the idea of my painting, which is the “subject” of my pride (this association constitutes the second relation in the double relation).

According to Hume, the three other principal indirect passions arise in parallel ways. For example, if my painting is ugly and causes me pain, then I will experience the secondary passion of humility—perhaps more accurately expressed as “humiliation”. By contrast, if someone else paints a pleasing picture, then this will trigger in me a feeling of love for that artist—perhaps more accurately expressed as “esteem”. If the artist paints a painfully ugly picture, then this will trigger in me a feeling of “hatred” towards the artist—perhaps more accurately expressed as “disesteem”.

One of the most lasting contributions of Hume’s discussion of the passions is his argument that human actions must be prompted by passion, and never can be motivated by reason. Reason, he argues, is completely inert when it comes to motivating conduct, and without some emotion we would not engage in any action. Thus, he writes, “Reason is, and ought only to be the slave of the passions, and can never pretend to any other office than to serve and obey them” (Treatise, 2.3.3.4).

6. Religious Belief

Like many of Hume’s philosophical views, his position on religious belief is also skeptical. Critics of religion during the eighteenth-century needed to express themselves cautiously to avoid being fined, imprisoned, or worse. Sometimes this involved placing controversial views in the mouth of a character in a dialogue. Other times it involved adopting the persona of a deist or fideist as a means of concealing a more extreme religious skepticism. Hume used all of the rhetorical devices at his disposal, and left it to his readers to decode his most controversial conclusions on religious subjects. During the Enlightenment, there were two pillars of traditional Christian belief: natural and revealed religion. Natural religion involves knowledge of God drawn from nature through the use of logic and reason, and typically involves logical proofs regarding the existence and nature of God, such as the causal and design arguments for God’s existence. Revealed religion involves knowledge of God contained in revelation, particularly the Bible, the quintessential examples of which are biblical prophesies and miracles where God intervenes in earthly affairs to confirm the Bible’s message of salvation. Hume attacks both natural and revealed religious beliefs in his various writings.

a. Miracles

In a 1737 letter to Henry Home, Hume states that he intended to include a discussion of miracles in his Treatise, but ultimately left it out for fear of offending readers. His analysis of the subject eventually appeared some ten years later in his essay “Of Miracles” from the Enquiry, and is his first sustained attack on revealed religion. It is probably this main argument to which Hume refers. The first of this two-part essay contains the argument for which Hume is most famous: uniform experience of natural law outweighs the testimony of any alleged miracle. Let us imagine a scale with two balancing pans. In the first pan we place the strongest evidence in support of the occurrence of a miracle. In the second we place our life-long experience of consistent laws of nature. According to Hume, the second pan will always outweigh the first. He writes:

It is experience only, which gives authority to human testimony [regarding miracles]; and it is the same experience, which assures us of the laws of nature. When, therefore, these two kinds of experience are contrary, we have nothing to do but subtract the one from the other, and embrace an opinion, either on one side or the other, with that assurance which arises from the remainder. But according to the principle here explained, this subtraction, with regard to all popular religions, amounts to an entire annihilation [Enquiry, 10.1].

Regardless of how strong the testimony is in favor of a given miracle, it can never come close to counterbalancing the overwhelming experience of unvaried laws of nature. Thus, proportioning one’s belief to the evidence, the wise person must reject the weaker evidence concerning the alleged miracle.

In the second part of “Of Miracles”, Hume discusses four factors that count against the credibility of most miracle testimonies: (1) witnesses of miracles typically lack integrity; (2) we are naturally inclined to enjoy sensational stories, and this has us uncritically perpetuate miracle accounts; (3) miracle testimonies occur most often in less civilized countries; and (4) miracles support rival religious systems and thus discredit each other. But even if a miracle testimony is not encumbered by these four factors, we should still not believe it since it would be contrary to our consistent experience of laws of nature. He concludes his essay with the following cryptic comment about Christian belief in biblical miracles:

upon the whole, we may conclude, that the Christian Religion not only was at first attended with miracles, but even at this day cannot be believed by any reasonable person without one. Mere reason is insufficient to convince us of its veracity: And whoever is moved by Faith to assent to it, is conscious of a continued miracle in his own person, which subverts all the principles of his understanding, and gives him a determination to believe what is most contrary to custom and experience [Enquiry, 10.2].

At face value, his comment suggests a fideist approach to religious belief such as what Pascal recommends. That is, reason is incapable of establishing religious belief, and God must perform a miracle in our lives to make us open to belief through faith. However, according to the eighteenth-century Hume critic John Briggs, Hume’s real point is that belief in Christianity requires “miraculous stupidity” (The Nature of Religious Zeal, 1775).

b. Psychology of Religious Belief

Another attack on revealed religion appears in Hume’s essay “The Natural History of Religion” (1757). It is one of the first systematic attempts to explain the causes of religious belief solely in terms of psychological and sociological factors. We might see the “Natural History” as an answer to a challenge, such as the sort that William Adams poses here in his attack on Hume’s “Of Miracles”:

Whence could the religion and laws of this people [i.e., the Jews] so far exceed those of the wisest Heathens, and come out at once, in their first infancy, thus perfect and entire; when all human systems are found to grow up by degrees, and to ripen, after many improvements; into perfection [An Essay, Part 2]?

According to Adams, only divine intervention can account for the sophistication of the ancient Jewish religion. In the “Natural History,” though, Hume offers an alternative explanation, and one that is grounded solely in human nature, without God’s direct involvement in human history.

The work may be divided into three parts. In the first (Sections 1 and 4), Hume argues that polytheism, and not monotheism, was the original religion of primitive humans. Monotheism, he believes, was only a later development that emerged with the progress of various societies. The standard theory in Judeo-Christian theology was that early humans first believed in a single God, but as religious corruption crept in, people lapsed into polytheism. Hume was the first writer to systematically defend the position of original polytheism. In the second part (Sections 2-3, 5-8), Hume establishes the psychological principles that give rise to popular religious belief. His thesis is that natural instincts—such as fear and the propensity to adulate—are the true causes of popular religious belief, and not divine intervention or rational argument. The third part of this work (Sections 9-15) compares various aspects of polytheism with monotheism, showing that one is no more superior than the other. Both contain points of absurdity. From this he concludes that we should suspend belief on the entire subject of religious truth.

c. Arguments for God’s Existence

Around the same time that Hume was composing his “Natural History of Religion” he was also working on his Dialogues Concerning Natural Religion, which appeared in print two decades later, after his death. As the title of the work implies, it is a critique of natural religion, in contrast with revealed religion. There are three principal characters in the Dialogues. A character named Cleanthes, who espouses religious empiricism, defends the design argument for God’s existence, but rejects the causal argument. Next, a character named Demea, who is a religious rationalist, defends the causal argument for God’s existence, but rejects the design argument. Finally, a character named Philo, who is a religious skeptic, argues against both the design and causal arguments. The main assaults on theistic proofs are conveyed by both Cleanthes and Philo, and, to that extent, both of their critiques likely represent Hume’s views.

The specific version of the causal argument that Hume examines is one by Samuel Clarke (and Leibniz before him). Simplistic versions of the causal argument maintain that when we trace back the causes of things in the universe, the chain of causes cannot go back in time to infinity past; there must be a first cause to the causal sequence, which is God. Clarke’s version differs in that it is theoretically possible for causal sequences of events to trace back through time to infinity past. Thus, we cannot argue that God’s existence is required to initiate a sequence of temporal causes. Nevertheless, Clarke argued, an important fact still needs to be explained: the fact that this infinite temporal sequence of causal events exists at all. Why does something exist rather than nothing? God, then, is the necessary cause of the whole series. In response, the character Cleanthes argues that the flaw in the cosmological argument consists in assuming that there is some larger fact about the universe that needs explaining beyond the particular items in the series itself. Once we have a sufficient explanation for each particular fact in the infinite sequence of events, it makes no sense to inquire about the origin of the collection of these facts. That is, once we adequately account for each individual fact, this constitutes a sufficient explanation of the whole collection. He writes, “Did I show you the particular causes of each individual in a collection of twenty particles of matter, I should think it very unreasonable, should you afterwards ask me, what was the cause of the whole twenty” (Dialogues, 9).

The design argument for God’s existence is that the appearance of design in the natural world is evidence for the existence of a divine designer. The specific version of the argument that Hume examines is one from analogy, as stated here by Cleanthes:

The curious adapting of means to ends, throughout all nature, resembles exactly, though it much exceeds, the productions of human contrivance; of human designs, thought, wisdom, and intelligence. Since, therefore, the effects resemble each other, we are led to infer, by all the rules of analogy, that the causes also resemble; and that the Author of Nature is somewhat similar to the mind of man (Dialogues, 2).

Philo presents several criticisms against the design argument, many of which are now standard in discussions of the issue. According to Philo, the design argument is based on a faulty analogy: we do not know whether the order in nature was the result of design, since, unlike our experience with the creation of machines, we did not witness the formation of the world. In Philo’s words, “will any man tell me with a serious countenance, that an orderly universe must arise from some thought and art like the human, because we have experience of it? To ascertain this reasoning, it were requisite that we had experience of the origin of worlds; and it is not sufficient, surely, that we have seen ships and cities arise from human art and contrivance” (ibid). Further, the vastness of the universe also weakens any comparison with human artifacts. Although the universe is orderly here, it may be chaotic elsewhere. Similarly, if intelligent design is exhibited only in a small fraction of the universe, then we cannot say that it is the productive force of the whole universe. Philo states that “A very small part of this great system, during a very short time, is very imperfectly discovered to us; and do we thence pronounce decisively concerning the origin of the whole?” (ibid). Philo also argues that natural design may be accounted for by nature alone, insofar as matter may contain within itself a principle of order, and “This at once solves all difficulties” (Dialogues, 6). And even if the design of the universe is of divine origin, we are not justified in concluding that this divine cause is a single, all powerful, or all good being. According to Philo, “Whether all these attributes are united in one subject, or dispersed among several independent beings, by what phenomena in nature can we pretend to decide the controversy?” (Dialogues 5).

7. Moral Theory

Hume’s moral theory appears in Book 3 of the Treatise and in An Enquiry Concerning the Principles of Morals (1751). He opens his discussion in the Treatise by telling us what moral approval is not: it is not a rational judgment about either conceptual relations or empirical facts. To make his case he criticizes Samuel Clarke’s rationalistic account of morality, which is that we rationally judge the fitness or unfitness of our actions in reference to eternal laws of righteousness, that are self-evidently known to all humans, just as is our knowledge of mathematical relations. Hume presents several arguments against Clarke’s view, one of which is an analogy from arboreal parricide: a young tree that overgrows and kills its parent exhibits the same alleged relations as a human child killing his parent. “Is not the one tree the cause of the other’s existence; and the latter the cause of the destruction of the former, in the same manner as when a child murders his parent?” (Treatise, 3.1.1.24). If morality is a question of relations, then the young tree is immoral, which is absurd. Hume also argues that moral assessments are not judgments about empirical facts. Take any immoral action, such as willful murder: “examine it in all lights, and see if you can find that matter of fact, or real existence, which you call vice” (Treatise, 3.1.1.25). You will not find any such fact, but only your own feelings of disapproval. In this context Hume makes his point that we cannot derive statements of obligation from statements of fact. When surveying various moral theories, Hume writes, “I am surpriz’d to find, that instead of the usual copulations of propositions, is, and is not, I meet with no proposition that is not connected with an ought or an ought not” (Treatise, 3.1.1.26). This move from is to ought is illegitimate, he argues, and is why people erroneously believe that morality is grounded in rational judgments.

Thus far Hume has only told us what moral approval is not, namely a judgment of reason. So what then does moral approval consist of? It is an emotional response, not a rational one. The details of this part of his theory rest on a distinction between three psychologically distinct players: the moral agent, the receiver, and the moral spectator. The moral agent is the person who performs an action, such as stealing a car; the receiver is the person impacted by the conduct, such as the owner of the stolen car; and the moral spectator is the person who observes and, in this case, disapproves of the agent’s action. This agent-receiver-spectator distinction is the product of earlier moral sense theories championed by the Earl of Shaftesbury (1671-1713), Joseph Butler (1692-1752), and Francis Hutcheson (1694-1747). Most generally, moral sense theories maintained that humans have a faculty of moral perception, similar to our faculties of sensory perception. Just as our external senses detect qualities in external objects, such as colors and shapes, so too does our moral faculty detect good and bad moral qualities in people and actions.

For Hume, all actions of a moral agent are motivated by character traits, specifically either virtuous or vicious character traits. For example, if you donate money to a charity, then your action is motivated by a virtuous character trait. Hume argues that some virtuous character traits are instinctive or natural, such as benevolence, and others are acquired or artificial, such as justice. As an agent, your action will have an effect on a receiver. For example, if you as the agent give food to a starving person, then the receiver will experience an immediately agreeable feeling from your act. Also, the receiver may see the usefulness of your food donation, insofar as eating food will improve his health. When considering the usefulness of your food donation, then, the receiver will receive another agreeable feeling from your act. Finally, I, as a spectator, observe these agreeable feelings that the receiver experiences. I, then, will sympathetically experience agreeable feelings along with the receiver. These sympathetic feelings of pleasure constitute my moral approval of the original act of charity that you, the agent, perform. By sympathetically experiencing this pleasure, I thereby pronounce your motivating character trait to be a virtue, as opposed to a vice. Suppose, on the other hand, that you as an agent did something to hurt the receiver, such as steal his car. I as the spectator would then sympathetically experience the receiver’s pain and thereby pronounce your motivating character trait to be a vice, as opposed to a virtue.

In short, that is Hume’s overall theory. There are, though, some important details that should also be mentioned. First, it is tricky to determine whether an agent’s motivating character trait is natural or artificial, and Hume decides this one virtue at a time. For Hume, the natural virtues include benevolence, meekness, charity, and generosity. By contrast, the artificial virtues include justice, keeping promises, allegiance and chastity. Contrary to what one might expect, Hume classifies the key virtues that are necessary for a well-ordered state as artificial, and he classifies only the more supererogatory virtues as natural. Hume’s critics were quick to point out this paradox. Second, to spark a feeling of moral approval, the spectator does not have to actually witness the effect of an agent’s action upon a receiver. The spectator might simply hear about it, or the spectator might even simply invent an entire scenario and think about the possible effects of hypothetical actions. This happens when we have moral reactions when reading works of fiction: “a very play or romance may afford us instances of this pleasure, which virtue conveys to us; and pain, which arises from vices” (Treatise, 3.1.2.2).

Third, although the agent, receiver, and spectator have psychologically distinct roles, in some situations a single person may perform more than one of these roles. For example, if I as an agent donate to charity, as a spectator to my own action I can also sympathize with the effect of my donation on the receiver. Finally, given various combinations of spectators and receivers, Hume concludes that there are four irreducible categories of qualities that exhaustively constitute moral virtue: (1) qualities useful to others, which include benevolence, meekness, charity, justice, fidelity and veracity; (2) qualities useful to oneself, which include industry, perseverance, and patience; (3) qualities immediately agreeable to others, which include wit, eloquence and cleanliness; and (4) qualities immediately agreeable to oneself, which include good humor, self-esteem and pride. For Hume, most morally significant qualities and actions seem to fall into more than one of these categories. When Hume spoke about an agent’s “useful” consequences, he often used the word “utility” as a synonym. This is particularly so in the Enquiry Concerning the Principles of Morals where the term “utility” appears over 50 times. Moral theorists after Hume thus depicted his moral theory as the “theory of utility”—namely, that morality involves assessing the pleasing and painful consequences of actions on the receiver. It is this concept and terminology that inspired classic utilitarian philosophers, such as Jeremy Bentham (1748–1832).

8. Aesthetic, Political, and Economic Theory

Hume wrote two influential essays on the subject of aesthetic theory. In “Of Tragedy” (1757) he discusses the psychological reasons why we enjoy observing depictions of tragic events in theatrical production. He argues that “the energy of expression, the power of numbers, and the charm of imitation” convey the sense of pleasure. He particularly stresses the technical artistry involved when an artistic work imitates the original. In “Of the Standard of Taste” (1757) he argues that there is a uniform sense of artistic judgment in human nature, similar to our uniform sense of moral judgment. Specific objects consistently trigger feelings of beauty within us, as our human nature dictates. Just as we can refine our external senses such as our palate, we can also refine our sense of artistic beauty and thus cultivate a delicacy of taste. In spite of this uniform standard of taste, two factors create some difference in our judgments: “the one is the different humours of particular men; the other, the particular manners and opinions of our age and country.”

In political theory, Hume has both theoretical discussions on the origins of government and more informal essays on popular political controversies of his day. In his theoretical discussions, he attacks two basic notions in eighteenth-century political philosophy: the social contract and the instinctive nature of justice regarding private property. In his 1748 essay “Of the Original Contract,” he argues that political allegiance is not grounded in any social contract, but instead on our general observation that society cannot be maintained without a governmental system. He concedes that in savage times there may have been an unwritten contract among tribe members for the sake of peace and order. However, he argues, this was no permanent basis of government as social contract theorists pretend. There is nothing to transmit that original contract onwards from generation to generation, and our experience of actual political events shows that governmental authority is founded on conquest, not elections or consent. We do not even tacitly consent to a contract since many of us have no real choice about remaining in our countries: “Can we seriously say that a poor peasant or artisan has a free choice to leave his country, when he knows no foreign language or manners, and lives from day to day by the small wages which he acquires?” Political allegiance, he concludes, is ultimately based on a primary instinct of selfishness, and only through reflection will we see how we benefit from an orderly society.

Concerning private property, in both the Treatise and the Enquiry Concerning the Principles of Morals (1751), Hume in essence argues against Locke’s notion of the natural right to private property. For Hume, we have no primary instinct to recognize private property, and all conceptions of justice regarding property are founded solely on how useful the convention of property is to us. We can see how property ownership is tied to usefulness when considering scenarios concerning the availability of necessities. When necessities are in overabundance, I can take what I want any time, and there is no usefulness in my claiming any property as my own. When the opposite happens and necessities are scarce, I do not acknowledge anyone’s claim to property and take what I want from others for my own survival. Thus, “the rules of equity or justice [regarding property] depend entirely on the particular state and condition in which men are placed, and owe their origin and existence to that utility, which results to the public from their strict and regular observance” (Enquiry Concerning the Principles of Morals, 3). Further, if we closely inspect human nature, we will never find a primary instinct that inclines us to acknowledge private property. It is nothing like the primary instinct of nest building in birds. While the sense of justice regarding private property is a firmly fixed habit, it is nevertheless its usefulness to society that gives it value.

As for Hume’s informal essays on popular political controversies, several of these involve party disputes between the politically conservative Tory party that supported a strong monarchy, and the politically liberal Whig party which supported a constitutional government. Two consistent themes emerge in these essays. First, in securing peace, a monarchy with strong authority is probably better than a pure republic. Hume sides with the Tories because of their traditional support of the monarchy. Except in extreme cases, he opposes the Lockean argument offered by Whigs that justifies overthrowing political authorities when those authorities fail to protect the rights of the people. Hume notes, though, that monarchies and republics each have their strong points. Monarchies encourage the arts, and republics encourage science and trade. Hume also appreciates the mixed form of government within Great Britain, which fosters liberty of the press. The second theme in Hume’s political essays is that revolutions and civil wars principally arise from zealousness within party factions. Political moderation, he argues, is the best antidote to potentially ruinous party conflict.

In economic theory, Hume wrote influential essays on money, interest, trade, credit, and taxes. Many of these target the mercantile system and its view that a country increases its wealth by increasing the quantity of gold and silver in that country. For mercantilists, three means were commonly employed to this end: (1) capture gold, silver and raw material from other countries through colonization; (2) discourage imports through tariffs and monopolies, which keeps acquired gold and silver within one’s country’s borders; and, (3) increase exports, which brings in money from outside countries. In Great Britain, mercantile policies were instituted through the Navigation Acts, which prohibited trade between British colonies and foreign countries. These protectionist laws ultimately led to the American Revolution. The most famous of Hume’s anti-mercantilist arguments is now called Hume’s gold-flow theory, and appears in his essays “Of Money” (1752) and “Of the Balance of Trade” (1752). Contrary to mercantilists who advocated locking up money in one’s home country, Hume argued that increased money in one country automatically disperses to other countries. Suppose, for example, that Great Britain receives an influx of new money. This new money will drive up prices of labor and domestic products in Great Britain. Products in foreign countries, then, will be cheaper than in Great Britain; Britain, then, will import these products, thereby sending new money to foreign countries. Hume compares this reshuffling of wealth to the level of fluids in interconnected chambers: if I add fluid to one chamber, then, under the weight of gravity, this will disperse to the others until the level is the same in all chambers. A similar phenomenon will occur if we lose money in our home country by purchasing imports from foreign countries. As the quantity of money decreases in our home country, this will drive down the prices of labor and domestic products. Our products, then, will be cheaper than foreign products, and we will gain money through exports. On the fluid analogy, by removing fluid from one chamber, more fluid is drawn in from surrounding chambers.

9. History and Philosophy

Although Hume is now remembered mainly as a philosopher, in his own day he had at least as much impact as a historian. His History of England appeared in four installments between 1754 and 1762 and covers the periods of British history from most ancient times through the seventeenth-century. To his 18th and 19th century readers, he was not just another historian, but a uniquely philosophical historian who had an ability to look into the minds of historical figures and uncover the motives behind their conduct. A political theme underlying the whole History is, once again, a conflict between Tory and Whig ideology. In the Britain of Hume’s day, a major point of contention between the two parties was whether the English government was historically an absolute or limited monarchy. Tories believed that it was traditionally absolute, with governmental authority being grounded in royal prerogative. Whigs, on the other hand, believed that it was traditionally limited, with the foundation of government resting in the individual liberty of the people, as expressed in the parliamentary voice of the commons. As a historian, Hume felt that he was politically moderate, tending to see both the strengths and weaknesses in opposing viewpoints:

With regard to politics and the character of princes and great men, I think I am very moderate. My views of things are more conformable to Whig principles; my representations of persons to Tory prejudices. Nothing can so much prove that men commonly regard more persons than things, as to find that I am commonly numbered among the Tories [Hume to John Clephane, 1756].

However, to radical Whig British readers, Hume was a conservative Tory who defended royal prerogative.

Hume takes two distinct positions on the prerogative issue. From a theoretical and idealistic perspective, he favored a mixed constitution, mediating between the authority of the monarch and that of the Parliament. Discussing this issue in his 1741 Essays, he holds that we should learn “the lesson of moderation in all our political controversies.” However, from the perspective of how British history actually unfolded, he emphasized royal prerogative. And, as a “philosophical historian,” he tried to show how human nature gave rise to the tendency towards royal prerogative. In his brief autobiography, “My Own Life,” he says that he rejected the “senseless clamour” of Whig ideology, and believed “It is ridiculous to consider the English constitution before that period [of the Stuart Monarchs] as a regular plan of liberty.” Gilbert Stuart best encapsulated Hume’s historical stance on the prerogative issue: “his history, from its beginning to its conclusion, is chiefly to be regarded as a plausible defence of prerogative” (A View of Society in Europe, 1778, 2.1.1). In short, Hume’s Tory narrative is this. As early as the Anglo Saxon period, the commons did not participate in the king’s advisory council. The Witenagemot, for example, was only a council of nobles and bishops, which the king could listen to or ignore as he saw fit. Throughout the succeeding centuries, England’s great kings were those who exercised absolute rule, and took advantage of prerogative courts such as the Star Chamber. Elizabeth—England’s most beloved monarch—was in fact a tyrant, and her reign was much like that of a Turkish sultan. Charles I—a largely virtuous man—tried to follow in her footsteps as a strong monarch. After a few minor lapses in judgment, and a few too many concessions to Catholics, Protestant zealots rose up against him, and he was ultimately executed. To avoid over-characterizing royal prerogative, Hume occasionally condemns arbitrary actions of monarchs and praises efforts for preserving liberty. Nevertheless, Whig critics like Gilbert Stuart argued that Hume’s emphasis was decisively in favor of prerogative.

There is an irony to Hume’s preference for prerogative over civil liberty. His philosophical writings were among the most controversial pieces of literature of the time, and would have been impossible to publish if Britain was not a friend to liberty. Although Hume was certainly no enemy to liberty, he believed that it was best achieved through moderation rather than Whig radicalism. He writes, “If any other rule than established practice be followed, factions and dissentions must multiply without end” (History, Appendix 3). To Hume’s way of thinking, the loudest voices favoring liberty were Calvinistic religious fanatics who accomplished little more than dissention. A strong, centralized and moderating force was the best way to avoid factious disruption from the start.

10. References and Further Reading

a. Recent Editions of Hume’s Writings

There are many published editions of Hume’s writings, the best of which are as follows (listed chronologically).

The Philosophical Works of David Hume (1874-1875), ed. T.H. Green and T.H. Grose.
- This four-volume set was the definitive edition of the late nineteenth century, and is the text source of many individually published books on Hume. It does not include the History. Electronic versions of this edition are freely available on the internet.
Hume’s Dialogues Concerning Natural Religion (1935), ed., Norman Kemp Smith.
- This is the definitive edition of this work, and contains a ground-breaking introductory essay.
Enquiries (Oxford, 1975) ed. L.A. Selby-Bigge and P.H. Nidditch.
- This contains Hume’s two Enquiries, and was the definitive edition of these works in the late twentieth-century.
Treatise of Human Nature (Oxford, 1978), ed. L.A. Selby-Bigge and P.H. Nidditch.
- This was the definitive edition of this work in the late twentieth-century.
History of England (Liberty Classics, 1983).
- This is the definitive edition of this work.
Essays, Moral, Political and Literary (Liberty Classics, 1987), ed. E.F. Miller.
- This is the definitive edition of this work.
The Clarendon Edition of the Works of David Hume (1998-ongoing), ed. Tom L. Beauchamp, Mark Box, David Fate Norton, Mary Norton, M.A. Stewart.
- This is a carefully-researched critical edition of Hume’s philosophical works, and supersedes all previous editions. Volumes on Hume’s Essays and the Dialogues are forthcoming; it does not include Hume’s History.

b. Chronological List of Hume’s Publications

A Treatise of Human Nature: Being an Attempt to Introduce the Experimental Method of Reasoning into Moral Subjects (1739-40).
- This was published anonymously in three volumes: Vol. I. Of the Understanding; Vol. II. Of the Passions. Vol. III. Of Morals. This is Hume’s principle philosophical work, the central notions of which were rewritten more popularly in Philosophical Essays Concerning Human Understanding (1748) and An Enquiry Concerning the Principles of Morals (1751).
An Abstract of a Book lately Published; entituled, A Treatise of Human Nature, &c. Wherein the chief Argument of that Book is farther Illustrated and Explained (1740).
- This is a sixteen page pamphlet, published anonymously as an effort to bring attention to the Treatise.
Essays, Moral and Political (1741-1742).
- This was published anonymously in two volumes in 1741 and 1742 respectively. In subsequent editions some essays were dropped and others added; the collection was eventually combined with his Political Discourses (1752) and retitled Essays, Moral, Political and Literary in Hume’s collection of philosophical works, Essays and Treatises on Several Subjects (1753).
A Letter from a Gentleman to his Friend in Edinburgh: Containing Some Observations on a Specimen of the Principles concerning Religion and Morality, said to be maintain’d in a Book lately publish’d, intituled, A Treatise of Human Nature, &c (1745).
- This thirty-four page pamphlet was published anonymously and was prompted by Hume’s candidacy for the Chair of Moral Philosophy at the University of Edinburgh. The pamphlet responds to criticisms regarding the Treatise.
Philosophical Essays Concerning Human Understanding. By the Author of the Essays Moral and Political (1748).
- This was published anonymously and later retitled Enquiry Concerning Human Understanding. It is a popularized version of key themes that appear mainly in the Treatise, Book 1.
A True Account of the Behaviour and conduct of Archibald Stewart, Esq; late Lord Provost of Edinburgh. In a letter to a Friend (1748).
- This fifty-one page pamphlet was published anonymously as a defense of Archibald Stewart, Lord Provost of Edinburgh, surrounding a political controversy.
An Enquiry Concerning the Principles of Morals. By David Hume, Esq. (1751).
- This is a popularized version of key themes that appear mainly in the Treatise, Book 3.
The Petition of the Grave and Venerable Bellmen (or Sextons) of the Church of Scotland (1751).
- This was published anonymously and involved the Church of Scotland’s efforts to increase their stipends.
Political discourses. By David Hume Esq. (1752).
- This is a collection of essays on economic and political subjects, which was eventually combined with his Essays Moral and Political (1741-1742) and retitled Essays, Moral, Political and Literary in Hume’s collection of philosophical works, Essays and Treatises on Several Subjects (1753).
Scotticisms (1752).
- This six page pamphlet was published anonymously, and lists Scottish idioms.
The History of England, from the Invasion of Julius Cæsar to the Revolution in 1688 (1754-1762).
- This was published in four installments: (a) The history of Great Britain. Vol. I. Containing the reigns of James I. and Charles I. By David Hume, Esq. (1754); (b) The history of Great Britain. Vol. II. Containing the Commonwealth, and the reigns of Charles II. and James II. By David Hume, Esq. (1757); (c) The history of England, under the House of Tudor Comprehending the reigns of K. Henry VII. K. Henry VIII. K. Edward VI. Q. Mary, and Q. Elizabeth. . . . By David Hume, Esq (1759); (d) The history of England, from the invasion of Julius Cæsar to the accession of Henry VII. . . . By David Hume, Esq. (1762).
Essays and Treatises on Several Subjects. By David Hume, Esq; In four volumes (1753).
- This is Hume’s handpicked collection of philosophical works, which includes (a) Essays, Moral and Political, (b) Philosophical Essays concerning Human Understanding, (c) An Enquiry Concerning the Principles of Morals, and (d) Political Discourses. Essays from Four Dissertations (1757) were added to later editions. The collection does not include the Treatise.
Four Dissertations. I. The Natural History of Religion. II. Of the Passions. III. Of Tragedy. IV. Of the Standard of Taste. By David Hume, esq. (1757).
- This volume was originally to include “Of Suicide” and “Of the Immortality of the Soul,” which were removed at the last minute and appeared separately in 1783 in an unauthorized posthumous edition. The four essays in Four Dissertations were later added to various sections of Essays and Treatises on Several Subjects.
Letter to Critical Review, April 1759, Vol. 7. pp. 323-334.
- This is a defense of William Wilkie’s epic poem Epigoniad.
Exposé succinct de la contestation qui s’est élevée entre M. Hume et M. Rousseau, avec les pieces justificatives (1766).
- This is a pamphlet containing letters between Hume and Rousseau, published anonymously, translated from English by J.B.A. Suard. The pamphlet was translated back to English in A Concise and Genuine account of the Dispute between Mr. Hume and Mr. Rousseau: with the Letters that Passed Between them during their Controversy (1766).
Advertisement to Baron Manstein’s Memoirs of Russia, Historical, Political and Military, from MDCXXVII, to MDCXLIV (1770).
- This is an opening advertisement by Hume to Manstein’s work.
The Life of David Hume, Esq. Written by Himself (1777). This contains “My Own Life” and “Letter from Adam Smith, LL.D. to William Strahan, Esq.”
Dialogues Concerning Natural religion. By David Hume, Esq. (1779).
- This is a posthumous edition from Hume’s unpublished manuscript, and contains his most detailed attack on natural religion.
Essays on Suicide, and the Immortality of the Soul, ascribed to the late David Hume, Esq. Never before Published. With Remarks, intended as an Antidote to the Poison contained in these Performances, by the Editor. To which is added, Two Letters on Suicide, from Rosseau’s [sic] Eloisa (1783).
- This is an unauthorized publication of the two essays that were originally associated with Four Dissertations.

c. Biographies, Letters, Manuscripts

Burton, John Hill. Letters of Eminent Persons Addressed to David Hume: From the Papers Bequeathed by his Nephew to the Royal Society of Edinburgh. (1849).
- This book is a companion to collections of letters written by Hume, and contains letters written to Hume, which are preserved in the National Library of Scotland manuscript collection noted below.
Greig, J.Y.T. Letters of David Hume (1932), two volumes.
- This is the best collection of Hume’s letters (along with the supplementary volume by Klibansky below).
Greig, J.Y.T.; Beynon, Harold, eds. “Calendar of Hume MSS. in the possession of the Royal Society,” in Proceedings of the Royal Society of Edinburgh, 1931–1932, Vol. 52, pp. 1–138.
- This is a detailed list of the Hume manuscripts from National Library of Scotland manuscript collection, noted below. It includes a contents summary of each item, and was subsequently published separately in book.
Klibansky, Raymond; Mossner, Ernest. New Letters of David Hume (1954).
- This volume of letters is a supplement to Greig’s two volume collection above.
Waldmann, Felix. Further Letters of David Hume (2014).
- This volume contains newly discovered letters.
Mossner, E.C. The Life of David Hume (Oxford, 1980).
- This is the best biography of Hume.
National Library of Scotland (MS no. 23151–23163).
- This manuscript deposit contains thirteen large volumes assembled from papers collected by Hume’s family after his death. It includes around 150 letters by Hume, 525 letters to him, and several manuscripts of published and unpublished works, most importantly the manuscript of his Dialogues Concerning Natural Religion. This is the manuscript collection indexed by Greig and Beynon above.

d. Bibliographies

“The Hume Literature,” Hume Studies, 1977-present.
- Each year Hume Studies publishes an annual bibliographical update; these bibliographies exclude articles that appear in Hume Studies itself.
“An Index of Hume Studies: 1975-1993.” Hume Studies 19.2 (1993).
- This is a bibliographical index of articles that have appeared in Hume Studies since the journal’s inception until 1993.
Fieser, James. A Bibliography of Hume’s Writings and Early Responses (2005).
- This is a bibliography of Hume’s writings and eighteenth and nineteenth-century responses. It is freely available on the internet.
Hall, Rolland. Fifty Years of Hume Scholarship: A Bibliographic Guide (1978).
- This bibliography covers from 1925 through 1976, and is continued by the annual Hume bibliographies in Hume Studies.
Jessop, Thomas Edmund. A bibliography of David Hume and of Scottish philosophy from Francis Hutcheson to Lord Balfour (1938).
- This is the first published scholarly bibliographical work on Hume, early responses to Hume, and other Scottish philosophers.
Tweyman, Stanley. Secondary Sources on the Philosophy of David Hume: A David Hume Bibliography in Two Volumes, 1741-2005 (2006).

e. Works on Hume

The secondary literature on Hume is voluminous. Below are a few works that cover all aspects of Hume’s philosophy. For works on specific aspects of Hume, such as his epistemology, see other IEP articles on Hume.

Ayer, A.J. Hume (1980).
- This is a short but informative introduction by a great twentieth-century philosopher who sees himself as following in the Humean tradition.
Blackburn, Simon. How to Read Hume (2008).
- This is a concise work on various aspects of Hume’s philosophy.
Fieser, James. Early Responses to Hume’s Writings (London: Continuum, 2005), 10 volumes.
- This contains the principal eighteenth and nineteenth-century criticisms of Hume, and is freely available on the internet.
Kemp Smith, Norman. The Philosophy of David Hume (1941).
- This groundbreaking book set a new direction for Hume scholarship.
Hume Studies, 1977-present.
- This journal is devoted to Hume scholarship, and most of the volumes are freely accessible on the Hume Studies web site.
Jones, Peter, ed. The Reception of David Hume in Europe. London, New York: Thoemmes Continuum, 2005.
- This work contains chapters by different writers on Hume’s impact in different European countries.
Norton, David Fate; Taylor, Jacqueline. The Cambridge Companion to Hume (2008).
- This contains essays by different writers on various aspects of Hume’s philosophy.
Stroud, Barry. Hume (1981).
- This is an influential analytic discussion of various problems that arise within Hume’s philosophy.

Author Information

James Fieser
Email: jfieser@utm.edu
University of Tennessee at Martin
U. S. A.

Causal Role Theories of Functional Explanation

Table of Contents

1. Background

2. Nagel’s Early Account

3. Difficulties

4. Cummins’ View

5. An Example

6. Objections and Replies

7. Other Developments

8. References and Further Reading

a. References

b. Suggested Reading

Author Information

The Third Earl of Shaftesbury (1671—1713)

Table of Contents

1. Life

2. Works

3. Aims and Methods

4. Major Themes

a. Moral Realism

b. Moral Beauty

c. Moral Sense

d. Personal Identity

5. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Texts

b. Secondary Texts

Author Information

Personalism

Table of Contents

1. South and East Asian Personalism

a. India

b. China and Japan

2. Historical Roots of Personalism in the Mediterranean Basin

3. European Development and Flowering

4. North American Personalism

a. Branches of Personalism

b. Major figures

i. Harvard University

ii. Boston University

iii. California

c. African Personalism

d. American Indian Personalism

5. Latin American Personalism

6. Current Trends

7. References and Further Reading

Author Information

Individualism in Classical Chinese Thought

Table of Contents

1. Dispute over “Individualism” in Chinese Philosophy

2. The Concept of Autonomy in Chinese Individualism

3. The Self as Individual

4. Individualism in Classical Confucian Thought

5. Moral Autonomy in the Mohist Writings

6. Individualism in the Zhuangzi

7. Individualism in the Thought of Yang Zhu

8. References and Further Reading

Author Information

Supervenience and Mind

Table of Contents

1. Supervenience: The Basic Idea

2. Supervenience and Non-Reductive Physicalism

3. Varieties of Supervenience

a. Global and Local Versions

b. Varieties of Necessitation

4. Two Common Complaints with Supervenience Theses

a. Explanatory Failure

b. Ontological Failure

5. Concluding Remarks

6. References and Further Readings

Author Information

Aquinas: Metaphysics

Table of Contents

1. The Nature of Metaphysics

2. Essence and Existence

3. Participation

4. Substance and Accident

5. Matter and Form

6. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

b. General Studies