Simone de Beauvoir (1908—1986)

Simone de Beauvoir was one of the most preeminent French existentialist philosophers and writers. Working alongside other famous existentialists such as Jean-Paul Sartre, Albert Camus and Maurice Merleau-Ponty, de Beauvoir produced a rich corpus of writings including works on ethics, feminism, fiction, autobiography, and politics.

Beauvoir’s method incorporated various political and ethical dimensions. In The Ethics of Ambiguity, she developed an existentialist ethics that condemned the “spirit of seriousness” in which people too readily identify with certain abstractions at the expense of individual freedom and responsibility.  In The Second Sex, she produced an articulate attack on the fact that throughout history women have been relegated to a sphere of “immanence,” and the passive acceptance of roles assigned to them by society.  In The Mandarins, she fictionalized the struggles of existents trapped in ambiguous social and personal relationships at the closing of World War II.  The emphasis on freedom, responsibility, and ambiguity permeate all of her works and give voice to core themes of existentialist philosophy.

Her philosophical approach is notably diverse. Her influences include French philosophy from Descartes to Bergson, the phenomenology of Edmund Husserl and Martin Heidegger, the historical materialism of Karl Marx and Friedrich Engels, and the idealism of Immanuel Kant and G. W. F Hegel. In addition to her philosophical pursuits, de Beauvoir was also an accomplished literary figure, and her novel, The Mandarins, received the prestigious Prix Goncourt award in 1954. Her most famous and influential philosophical work, The Second Sex (1949), heralded a feminist revolution and remains to this day a central text in the investigation of women’s oppression and liberation.

Table of Contents

1. Biography
2. Ethics
   1. Pyrrhus et Cineas
   2. The Ethics of Ambiguity
3. Feminism
   1. The Second Sex
4. Literature
   1. Novels
   2. Short Stories
   3. Theater
5. Cultural Studies
   1. Travel Observations
   2. The Coming of Age
   3. Autobiographical Works
6. References and Further Reading
   1. Selected Works by Beauvoir (in French and English)
   2. Selected Books on Beauvoir in English

1. Biography

Simone de Beauvoir was born on January 9, 1908 in Paris to Georges Bertrand de Beauvoir and Françoise (née) Brasseur. Her father, George, whose family had some aristocratic pretensions, had once desired to become an actor but studied law and worked as a civil servant, contenting himself instead with the profession of legal secretary. Despite his love of the theater and literature, as well as his atheism, he remained a staunchly conservative man whose aristocratic proclivities drew him to the extreme right. In December of 1906 he married Françoise Brasseur whose wealthy bourgeois family offered a significant dowry that was lost in the wake of World War I. Slightly awkward and socially inexperienced, Françoise was a deeply religious woman who was devoted to raising her children in the Catholic faith. Her religious, bourgeois orientation became a source of serious conflict between her and her oldest daughter, Simone. [The British refer to Simone de Beauvoir as “de Beauvoir” and the Americans, as “Beauvoir.”]

Born in the morning of January 9, 1908, Simone-Ernestine-Lucie-Marie Bertrand de Beauvoir was a precocious and intellectually curious child from the beginning. Her sister, Hélène (nicknamed “Poupette”) was born two years later in 1910 and Beauvoir immediately took to intensely instructing her little sister as a student. In addition to her own independent initiative, Beauvoir’s intellectual zeal was also nourished by her father who provided her with carefully edited selections from the great works of literature and who encouraged her to read and write from an early age. His interest in her intellectual development carried through until her adolescence when her future professional carrier, necessitated by the loss of her dowry, came to symbolize his own failure. Aware that he was unable to provide a dowry for his daughters, Georges’ relationship with his intellectually astute eldest became conflicted by both pride and disappointment at her prospects. Beauvoir, on the contrary, always wanted to be a writer and a teacher, rather than a mother and a wife and pursued her studies with vigor. Beauvoir began her education in the private Catholic school for girls, the Institut Adeline Désir where she remained until the age of 17. It was here that she met Elizabeth Mabille (Zaza), with whom she shared an intimate and profound friendship until Zaza’s untimely death in 1929. Although the doctor’s blamed Zaza’s death on meningitis, Beauvoir believed that her beloved friend had died from a broken heart in the midst of a struggle with her family over an arranged marriage. Zaza’s friendship and death haunted Beauvoir for the rest of her life and she often spoke of the intense impact they had on her life and her critique of the rigidity of bourgeois attitudes towards women.

Beauvoir had been a deeply religious child as a result of her education and her mother’s training; however, at the age of 14, she had a crisis of faith and decided definitively that there was no God. She remained an atheist until her death. Her rejection of religion was followed by her decision to pursue and teach philosophy. Only once had she considered marriage to her cousin, Jacques Champigneulle. She never again entertained the possibility of marriage, instead preferring to live the life of an intellectual.

Beauvoir passed the baccalauréat exams in mathematics and philosophy in 1925. She then studied mathematics at the Institut Catholique and literature and languages at the Institut Sainte-Marie, passing exams in 1926 for Certificates of Higher Studies in French literature and Latin, before beginning her study of philosophy in 1927. Studying philosophy at the Sorbonne, Beauvoir passed exams for Certificates in History of Philosophy, General Philosophy, Greek, and Logic in 1927, and in 1928, in Ethics, Sociology, and Psychology. She wrote a graduate diplôme on Leibniz for Léon Brunschvig and completed her practice teaching at the lycée Janson-de-Sailly with fellow students, Merleau-Ponty and Claude Lévi-Strauss – with both of whom she remained in philosophical dialogue.

In 1929, she took second place in the highly competitive philosophy agrégation exam, beating Paul Nizan and Jean Hyppolite and barely losing to Jean-Paul Sartre who took first (it was his second attempt at the exam). Unlike Beauvoir, all three men had attended the best preparatory (khâgne) classes for the agrégation and were official students at the École Normale Supérieure. Although she was not an official student, Beauvoir attended lectures and sat for the agrégation at the École Normale. At 21 years of age, Beauvoir was the youngest student ever to pass the agrégation in philosophy and thus became the youngest philosophy teacher in France.

It was during her time at the École Normale that she met Sartre. Sartre and his closed circle of friends (including René Maheu, who gave her her life-long nickname “Castor”, and Paul Nizan) were notoriously elitist at the École Normale. Beauvoir had longed to be a part of this intellectual circle and following her success in the written exams for the agrégation in 1929, Sartre requested to be introduced to her. Beauvoir thus joined Sartre and his “comrades” in study sessions to prepare for the grueling public oral examination component of the agrégation. For the first time, she found in Sartre an intellect worthy (and, as she asserted, in some ways superior) to her own-a characterization that has lead to many ungrounded assumptions concerning Beauvoir’s lack of philosophical originality. For the rest of their lives, they were to remain “essential” lovers, while allowing for “contingent” love affairs whenever each desired. Although never marrying (despite Sartre’s proposal in 1931), having children together, or even living in the same home, Sartre and Beauvoir remained intellectual and romantic partners until Sartre’s death in 1980.

The liberal intimate arrangement between her and Sartre was extremely progressive for the time and often unfairly tarnished Beauvoir’s reputation as a woman intellectual equal to her male counterparts. Adding to her unique situation with Sartre, Beauvoir had intimate liaisons with both women and men. Some of her more famous relationships included the journalist Jacques Bost, the American author Nelson Algren, and Claude Lanzmann, the maker of the Holocaust documentary, Shoah.

In 1931, Beauvoir was appointed to teach in a lycée at Marseilles whereas Sartre’s appointment landed him in Le Havre. In 1932, Beauvoir moved to the Lycée Jeanne d’Arc in Rouen where she taught advanced literature and philosophy classes. In Rouen she was officially reprimanded for her overt criticisms of woman’s situation and her pacifism. In 1940, the Nazis occupied Paris and in 1941, Beauvoir was dismissed from her teaching post by the Nazi government. As a result of the effects of World War II on Europe, Beauvoir began exploring the problem of the intellectual’s social and political engagement with his or her time.

Following a parental complaint made against her for corrupting one of her female students, she was dismissed from teaching again in 1943. She was never to return to teaching. Although she loved the classroom environment, Beauvoir had always wanted to be an author from her earliest childhood. Her collection of short stories on women, Quand prime le spirituel (When Things of the Spirit Come First) was rejected for publication and not published until many years later (1979). However, her fictionalized account of the triangular relationship between herself, Sartre and her student, Olga Kosakievicz, L’Invitée (She Came to Stay), was published in 1943. This novel, written from 1935 to 1937 (and read by Sartre in manuscript form as he began writing Being and Nothingness) successfully gained her public recognition.

The Occupation inaugurated what Beauvoir has called the “moral period” of her literary life. From 1941 to 1943 she wrote her novel, Le Sang des Autres (The Blood of Others), which was heralded as one of the most important existential novels of the French Resistance. In 1943 she wrote her first philosophical essay, an ethical treatise entitled Pyrrhus et Cinéas. Finally, this period includes the writing of her novel, Tous Les Hommes sont Mortels (All Men are Mortal), written from 1943-46 and her only play, Les Bouches Inutiles (Who Shall Die?), written in 1944.

Although only cursorily involved in the Resistance, Beauvoir’s political commitments underwent a progressive development in the 1930’s and 1940’s. Together with Sartre, Maurice Merleau-Ponty, Raymond Aron and other intellectuals, she helped found the politically non-affiliated, leftist journal, Les Temps Modernes in 1945, for which she both edited and contributed articles, including in 1945, “Moral Idealism and Political Realism,” “Existentialism and Popular Wisdom,” and in 1946, “Eye for an Eye.” Also in 1946, Beauvoir wrote an article explaining her method of doing philosophy in literature in “Literature and Metaphysics.” The creation of this journal and her leftist orientation (which was heavily influenced by her reading of Marx and the political ideal represented by Russia), colored her uneasy relationship to Communism. The journal itself and the question of the intellectual’s political commitments would become a major theme of her novel, The Mandarins (1954).

Beauvoir published another ethical treatise, Pour une Morale de l’Ambiguïté (The Ethics of Ambiguity) in 1947. Although she was never fully satisfied with this work, it remains one of the best examples of an existentialist ethics. In 1955, she published, “Must We Burn Sade?” which again approaches the question of ethics from the perspective of the demands of and obligations to the other.

Following advance extracts which appeared in Les Temps Modernes in 1948, Beauvoir published her revolutionary, two-volume investigation into woman’s oppression, Le Deuxième Sexe (The Second Sex) in 1949. Although previous to writing this work she had never considered herself to be a “feminist,” The Second Sex solidified her as a feminist figure for the remainder of her life. By far her most controversial work, this book was embraced by feminists and intellectuals, as well as mercilessly attacked by both the right and the left. The 70’s, famous for being a time of feminist movements, was embraced by Beauvoir who participated in demonstrations, continued to write and lecture on the situation of women, and signed petitions advocating various rights for women. In 1970, Beauvoir helped launch the French Women’s Liberation Movement in signing the Manifesto of the 343 for abortion rights and in 1973, she instituted a feminist section in Les Temps Modernes.

Following the numerous literary successes and the high profile of her and Sartre’s lives, her career was marked by a fame rarely experienced by philosophers during their lifetimes. This fame resulted both from her own work as well as from her relationship to and association with Sartre. For the rest of her life, she lived under the close scrutiny of the public eye. She was often unfairly considered to be a mere disciple of Sartrean philosophy (in part, due to her own proclamations) despite the fact that many of her ideas were original and went in directions radically different than Sartre’s works.

During the 1940’s, she and Sartre, who had at one time relished in the café culture and social life of Paris, found themselves retreating into the safety of their close circle of friends, affectionately named the “Family.” However, her fame did not stop her from continuing her life-long passion of traveling to foreign lands which resulted in two of her works, L’Amérique au Jour le Jour (America Day by Day) first published in 1948 and La Longue Marche (The Long March) published in 1957. The former was written following her lecture tour of the United States in 1947, and the latter following her visit with Sartre to communist China in 1955.

Her later work included the writing of more works of fiction, philosophical essays and interviews. It was notably marked not only by her political action in feminist issues, but also by the publication of her autobiography in four volumes and her political engagement directly attacking the French war in Algeria and the tortures of Algerians by French officers. In 1970, she published an impressive study of the oppression of aged members of society, La Vieillesse (The Coming of Age). This work mirrors the same approach she had taken in The Second Sex only with a different object of investigation.

Beauvoir saw the passing of her lifelong companion in 1980, which is recounted in her 1981 book, La Cérémonie des Adieux (Adieux: A Farewell to Sartre). Following the death of Sartre, Beauvoir officially adopted her companion, Sylvie le Bon, who became her literary executor. Beauvoir died of a pulmonary edema on April 14, 1986.

2. Ethics

a. Pyrrhus et Cineas

For most of her life, Beauvoir was concerned with the ethical responsibility that the individual has to him or herself, other individuals and to oppressed groups. Her early work, Pyrrhus et Cinéas (1944) approaches the question of ethical responsibility from an existentialist framework long before Sartre was to attempt the same endeavor. This essay was well-received as it spoke to a war-torn France that was struggling to find a way out of the darkness of War World II. It begins as a conversation between Pyrrhus, the ancient king of Epirus, and his chief advisor, Cineas, on the question of action. Each time Pyrrhus makes an assertion as to what land he will conquer, Cineas asks him what will he do afterwards? Finally, Pyrrhus exclaims that he will rest following the achievement of all of his plans, to which Cineas retorts, “Why not rest right away”? The essay is thus framed as an investigation into the motives of action and the existential concern with why we should act at all.

This work was written by a young Beauvoir in close dialogue with the Sartre of Being and Nothingness (1943). The framework of an individual freedom engaged in an objective world is close to Sartre’s conception of the conflict between being-for-itself (l’être-pour-soi) and being-in-itself (l’être-en-soi). Differing from Sartre, Beauvoir’s analysis of the free subject immediately implies an ethical consideration of other free subjects in the world. The external world can often manifest itself as a crushing, objective reality whereas the other can reveal to us our fundamental freedom. Lacking a God to guarantee morality, it is up to the individual existent to create a bond with others through ethical action. This bond requires a fundamentally active orientation to the world through projects that express our own freedom as well as encourage the freedom of our fellow human beings. Because to be human is essentially to rupture the given world through our spontaneous transcendence, to be passive is to live, in Sartrean terminology, in bad faith.

Although emphasizing key Sartrean motifs of transcendence, freedom and the situation in this early work, Beauvoir takes her enquiry in a different direction. Like Sartre, she believes that that human subjectivity is essentially a nothingness which ruptures being through spontaneous projects. This movement of rupturing the given through the introduction of spontaneous activity is called transcendence. Beauvoir, like Sartre, believes that the human being is constantly engaged in projects which transcend the factical situation (cultural, historical, personal, etc.) into which the existent is thrown. Yet, even though much of her nomenclature and ideas obviously emerge within a philosophical discourse with Sartre, her goal in writing Pyrrhus et Cinéas is somewhat different than his. Most notably, in Pyrrhus et Cinéas, she constructs an ethics, which is a project postponed by Sartre in Being and Nothingness. In addition, rather than seeing the other (who in his or her gaze turns me into an object) as a threat to my freedom as Sartre would have it, Beauvoir sees the other as the necessary axis of my freedom-without whom, in other words, I could not be free. With the goal of elucidating an existentialist ethics then, Beauvoir is concerned with questions of oppression that are largely absent in Sartre’s early work.

Pyrrhus et Cinéas is a richly philosophical text which incorporates themes not only from Sartre, but also from Hegel, Heidegger, Spinoza, Voltaire, Nietzsche, and Kierkegaard. However, Beauvoir is as critical of these philosophers as she is admiring. For example, she criticizes Hegel for his unethical faith in progress which sublates the individual in the relentless pursuit of the Absolute. She criticizes Heidegger for his emphasis on being-towards-death as undermining the necessity of setting up projects, which are themselves ends and are not necessarily projections towards death.

Beauvoir emphasizes that one’s transcendence is realized through the human project which sets up its own end as valuable, rather than relying on external validation or meaning. The end, therefore, is not something cut off from activity, standing as a static and absolute value outside of the existent who chooses it. Rather, the goal of action is established as an end through the very freedom which posits it as a worthwhile enterprise. Beauvoir maintains the existentialist belief in absolute freedom of choice and the consequent responsibility that such freedom entails, by emphasizing that one’s projects must spring from individual spontaneity and not from an external institution, authority, or person. As such, she is sharply critical of the Hegelian absolute, the Christian conception of God and abstract entities such as Humanity, Country and Science which demand the individual’s renunciation of freedom into a static Cause. All world-views which demand the sacrifice and repudiation of freedom diminish the reality, thickness, and existential importance of the individual existent. This is not to say that we should abandon all projects of unification and scientific advancement in favor of a disinterested solipsism, only that such endeavors must necessarily honor the individual existents of which they are composed. Additionally, instead of being forced into causes of various kinds, existents must actively and self-consciously choose to participate in them.

Because Beauvoir is so concerned in this essay with freedom and the necessity to self-consciously choose who one is at every moment, she takes up relationships of slavery, mastery, tyranny, and devotion which remain choices despite the inequalities that often result from these connections with others. Despite the inequity of power in such relationships, she maintains that we can never do anything for or against others, i.e., we can never act in the place of others because each individual can only be responsible for him or herself. However, we are still morally obligated to keep from harming others. Echoing a common theme in existentialist philosophy, even to be silent or to refuse to engage in helping the other, is still making a choice. Freedom, in other words, cannot be escaped.

Yet, she also develops the idea that in abstaining from encouraging the freedom of others, we are acting against the ethical call of the other. Without others, our actions are destined to fall back upon themselves as useless and absurd. However, with others who are also free, our actions are taken up and carried beyond themselves into the future-transcending the limits of the present and of our finite selves. Our very actions are calls to other freedoms who may choose to respond to or ignore us. Because we are finite and limited and there are no absolutes to which our actions can or should conform, we must carry out our projects in risk and uncertainty. But it is just this fragility that Beauvoir believes opens us up to a genuine possibility for ethics.

b. The Ethics of Ambiguity

In many ways, The Ethics of Ambiguity (1947) continues themes first developed in Pyrrhus et Cinéas. Beauvoir continues to believe in the contingency of existence in that there is no necessity that we exist and thus there is no predetermined human essence or standard of value. Of particular importance, Beauvoir expounds upon the idea that human freedom requires the freedom of others for it to be actualized. Although Beauvoir was never fully satisfied with The Ethics of Ambiguity, it remains a testament to her long-standing concern with freedom, oppression, and responsibility, as well as to the depth of her philosophical understanding of the history of philosophy and of her own unique contributions to it.

She begins this work by asserting the tragic condition of the human situation which experiences its freedom as a spontaneous internal drive that is crushed by the external weight of the world. Human existence, she argues, is always an ambiguous admixture of the internal freedom to transcend the given conditions of the world and the weight of the world which imposes itself on us in a manner outside of our control and not of our own choosing. In order for us to live ethically then, we must assume this ambiguity rather than try to flee it.

In Sartrean terms, she sets up a problem in which each existent wants to deny their paradoxical essence as nothingness by desiring to be in the strict, objective sense; a project that is doomed to failure and bad faith. In many ways, Beauvoir’s task is to describe the existentialist conversion alluded to by Sartre in Being and Nothingness, but postponed until the much later, incomplete attempt in his Cahiers Pour une Morale. For Beauvoir, an existentialist conversion allows us to live authentically at the crossroads of freedom and facticity. This requires that we engage our freedom in projects which emerge from a spontaneous choice. In addition, the ends and goals of our actions must never be set up as absolutes, separate from we who choose them. In this sense, Beauvoir sets limits to freedom. To be free is not to have free license to do whatever one wants. Rather, to be free entails the conscious assumption of this freedom through projects which are chosen at each moment. The meaning of actions is thus granted not from some external source of values (say in God, the church, the state, our family, etc.), but in the existent’s spontaneous act of choosing them. Each individual must positively assume his or her project (whether it be to write a novel, graduate from university, preside over a courtroom, etc.) and not try to escape freedom by escaping into the goal as into a static object. Thus, we act ethically only insofar as we accept the weight of our choices and the consequences and responsibilities of our fundamental, ontological freedom. As Beauvoir tells us, “to will oneself moral and to will oneself free are one and the same decision.”

The genuine human being thus does not recognize any foreign absolute not consciously and actively chosen by the person him or herself. This idea is perhaps best seen in Beauvoir’s critique of Hegel which runs throughout this text. Although Hegel is not the only philosopher with whom she is in dialogue (she addresses Kant, Marx, Descartes, and Sartre, as well) he represents the philosophical crystallization of the desire for human beings to escape their freedom by submerging it into an external absolute. Thus Hegel, for Beauvoir, sets up an “Absolute Subject” whose realization only comes at the end of history, thereby justifying the sacrifice of countless individuals in the relentless pursuit of its own perfection. As such, Hegel’s Absolute represents an abstraction which is taken as the truth of existence which annihilates instead of preserves the individual human lives which compose it. Only a philosophy which values the freedom of each individual existent can alone be ethical. Philosophies such as those of Hegel, Kant, and Marx which privilege the universal are built upon the necessary diminution of the particular and as such, cannot be authentically ethical systems. Beauvoir claims against these philosophers of the absolute, that existentialism embraces the plurality of the concrete, particular human beings enmeshed in their own unique situations and engaged in their own projects.

However, Beauvoir is also emphatic that even though existentialist ethics upholds the sanctity of individuals, an individual is always situated within a community and as such, separate existents are necessarily bound to each other. She argues that every enterprise is expressed in a world populated by and thus affecting other human beings. She defends this position by returning to an idea touched upon in Pyrrhus et Cinéas and more fully developed in the Ethics, which is that individual projects fall in upon themselves if there are not others with whom our projects intersect and who consequently carry our actions beyond us in space and time.

In order to illustrate the complexity of situated freedom, Beauvoir provides us with an important element of growth, development and freedom in The Ethics of Ambiguity. Most philosophers begin their discussions with a fully-grown, rational human being, as if only the adult concerns philosophical inquiry. However, Beauvoir incorporates an analysis of childhood in which she argues that the will, or freedom, is developed over time. Thus, the child is not considered moral because he or she does not have a connection to a past or future and action can only be understood as unfolding over time. In addition, the situation of the child gives us a glimpse into what Beauvoir calls the attitude of seriousness in which values are given, not chosen. In fact, it is because each person was once a child that the serious attitude is the most prevalent form of bad faith.

Describing the various ways in which existents flee their freedom and responsibility, Beauvoir catalogues a number of different inauthentic attitudes, which in various forms are all indicative of a flight from freedom. As the child is neither moral nor immoral, the first actual category of bad faith consists of the “sub-man” who, through boredom and laziness, restrains the original movement of spontaneity in the denial of his or her freedom. This is a dangerous attitude in which to live because even as the sub-man rejects freedom, he or she becomes a useful pawn to be recruited by the “serious man” to enact brutal, immoral and violent action. The serious man is the most common attitude of flight as he or she embodies the desire that all existents share to found their freedom in an objective, external standard. The serious man upholds absolute and unconditioned values to which he or she subordinates his or her freedom. The object into which the serious attitude attempts to merge itself is not important-it can be the Military for the general, Fame for the actress, Power for the politician-what is important is that the self is lost into it. But as Beauvoir has already told us, all action loses meaning if it is not willed from freedom, setting up freedom as its goal. Thus the serious man is the ultimate example of bad faith because rather than seeking to embrace freedom, he or she seeks to lose into an external idol. All existents are tempted to set up values of seriousness (say, for example, by claiming that one is a “republican” or a “liberal” as if these monikers were substantial “things” that defined us in any essential sense) so as to give meaning to their lives. But the attitude of seriousness gives rise to tyranny and oppression when the “Cause” is pronounced more important than those who comprise it.

Other attitudes of bad faith include the “nihilist” which is an attitude resulting from disappointed seriousness turned back on itself. When the general understands that the military is a false idol that does not justify his existence, he may become a nihilist and deny that the world has any meaning at all. The nihilist desires to be nothing which is not unlike the reality of human freedom for Beauvoir. However, the nihilist is not an authentic choice because he or she does not assert nothingness in the sense of freedom, but in the sense of denial. Although mentioning other interesting attitudes of bad faith (such as the “demoniacal man” and the “passionate man”) the last attitude of importance is the attitude of the “adventurer.” The adventurer is interesting because it is so close to an authentically moral attitude. Disdaining the values of seriousness and nihilism, the adventurer throws him or herself into life and chooses action for its own sake. But the adventurer cares only for his or her own freedom and projects, and thus embodies a selfish and potentially tyrannical attitude. The adventurer demonstrates a tendency to align him or herself with whoever will bestow power, pleasure and glory. And often those who bestow such gifts, do not have the welfare of humanity as their main concern.

One of Beauvoir’s greatest achievements in The Ethics of Ambiguity is found in her analyses of situation and mystification. For the early Sartre, one’s situation (or facticity) is merely that which is to be transcended in the spontaneous surge of freedom. The situation is certainly a limit, but it is a limit-to-be-surpassed. Beauvoir, however, recognizes that some situations are such that they cannot be simply transcended but serve as strict and almost unsurpassable inhibitors to action. For example, she tells us that there are oppressed peoples such as slaves and many women who exist in a childlike world in which values, customs, gods, and laws are given to them without being freely chosen. Their situation is defined not by the possibility of transcendence, but by the enforcement of external institutions and power structures. Because of the power exerted upon them, their limitations cannot, in many circumstances, be transcended because they are not even known. Their situation, in other words, appears to be the natural order of the world. Thus the slave and the woman are mystified into believing that their lot is assigned to them by nature. As Beauvoir explains, because we cannot revolt against nature, the oppressor convinces the oppressed that their situation is what it is because they are naturally inferior or slavish. In this way, the oppressor mystifies the oppressed by keeping them ignorant of their freedom, thereby preventing them from revolting. Beauvoir rightly points out that one simply cannot claim that those who are mystified or oppressed are living in bad faith. We can only judge the actions of those individuals as emerging from their situation.

Only the authentically moral attitude understands that the freedom of the self requires the freedom of others. To act alone or without concern for others is not to be free. As Beauvoir explains, “No project can be defined except by its interference with other projects.” Thus if my project intersects with others who are enslaved-either literally or through mystification-I too am not truly free. What is more, if I do not actively seek to help those who are not free, I am implicated in their oppression.

As this book was written after World War II, it is not so surprising that Beauvoir would be concerned with questions of oppression and liberation and the ethical responsibility that each of us has to each other. Clearly she finds the attitude of seriousness to be the leading culprit in nationalistic movements such as Nazism which manipulate people into believing in a Cause as an absolute and unquestionable command, demanding the sacrifice of countless individuals. Beauvoir pleads with us to remember that we can never prefer a Cause to a human being and that the end does not necessarily justify the means. In this sense, Beauvoir is able to promote an existential ethics which asserts the reality of individual projects and sacrifice while maintaining that such projects and sacrifices have meaning only in a community comprised of individuals with a past, present, and future.

3. Feminism

a. The Second Sex

Most philosophers agree that Beauvoir’s greatest contribution to philosophy is her revolutionary magnum opus, The Second Sex. Published in two volumes in 1949 (condensed into one text divided into two “books” in English), this work immediately found both an eager audience and harsh critics. The Second Sex was so controversial that the Vatican put it (along with her novel, The Mandarins) on the Index of prohibited books. At the time The Second Sex was written, very little serious philosophy on women from a feminist perspective had been done. With the exception of a handful of books, systematic treatments of the oppression of women both historically and in the modern age were almost unheard of. Striking for the breadth of research and the profundity of its central insights, The Second Sex remains to this day one of the foundational texts in philosophy, feminism, and women’s studies.

The main thesis of The Second Sex revolves around the idea that woman has been held in a relationship of long-standing oppression to man through her relegation to being man’s “Other.” In agreement with Hegelian and Sartrean philosophy, Beauvoir finds that the self needs otherness in order to define itself as a subject; the category of the otherness, therefore, is necessary in the constitution of the self as a self. However, the movement of self-understanding through alterity is supposed to be reciprocal in that the self is often just as much objectified by its other as the self objectifies it. What Beauvoir discovers in her multifaceted investigation into woman’s situation, is that woman is consistently defined as the Other by man who takes on the role of the Self. As Beauvoir explains in her Introduction, woman “is the incidental, the inessential, as opposed to the essential. He is the Subject, he is the Absolute-she is the Other.” In addition, Beauvoir maintains that human existence is an ambiguous interplay between transcendence and immanence, yet men have been privileged with expressing transcendence through projects, whereas women have been forced into the repetitive and uncreative life of immanence. Beauvoir thus proposes to investigate how this radically unequal relationship emerged as well as what structures, attitudes and presuppositions continue to maintain its social power.

The work is divided into two major themes. The first book investigates the “Facts and Myths” about women from multiple perspectives including the biological-scientific, psychoanalytic, materialistic, historical, literary and anthropological. In each of these treatments, Beauvoir is careful to claim that none of them is sufficient to explain woman’s definition as man’s Other or her consequent oppression. However, each of them contributes to woman’s overall situation as the Other sex. For example, in her discussion of biology and history, she notes the women experience certain phenomena such as pregnancy, lactation, and menstruation that are foreign to men’s experience and thus contribute to a marked difference in women’s situation. However, these physiological occurrences in no way directly cause woman to be man’s subordinate because biology and history are not mere “facts” of an unbiased observer, but are always incorporated into and interpreted from a situation. In addition, she acknowledges that psychoanalysis and historical materialism contribute tremendous insights into the sexual, familial and material life of woman, but fail to account for the whole picture. In the case of psychoanalysis, it denies the reality of choice and in the case of historical materialism, it neglects to take into account the existential importance of the phenomena it reduces to material conditions.

The most philosophically rich discussion of Book I comes in Beauvoir’s analysis of myths. There she tackles the way in which the preceding analyses (biological, historical, psychoanalytic, etc.) contribute to the formulation of the myth of the “Eternal Feminine.” This paradigmatic myth, which incorporates multiple myths of woman under it (such as the myth of the mother, the virgin, the motherland, nature, etc.) attempts to trap woman into an impossible ideal by denying the individuality and situation of all different kinds of women. In fact, the ideal set by the Eternal Feminine sets up an impossible expectation because the various manifestations of the myth of femininity appear as contradictory and doubled. For example, history shows us that for as many representations of the mother as the respected guardian of life, there are as many depictions of her as the hated harbinger of death. The contradiction that man feels at having been born and having to die gets projected onto the mother who takes the blame for both. Thus woman as mother is both hated and loved and individual mothers are hopelessly caught in the contradiction. This doubled and contradictory operation appears in all feminine myths, thus forcing women to unfairly take the burden and blame for existence.

Book II begins with Beauvoir’s most famous assertion, “One is not born, but rather becomes, a woman.” By this, Beauvoir means to destroy the essentialism which claims that women are born “feminine” (according to whatever the culture and time define it to be) but are rather constructed to be such through social indoctrination. Using a wide array of accounts and observations, the first section of Book II traces the education of woman from her childhood, through her adolescence and finally to her experiences of lesbianism and sexual initiation (if she has any). At each stage, Beauvoir illustrates how women are forced to relinquish their claims to transcendence and authentic subjectivity by a progressively more stringent acceptance of the “passive” and “alienated” role to man’s “active” and “subjective” demands. Woman’s passivity and alienation are then explored in what Beauvoir entitles her “Situation” and her “Justifications.” Beauvoir studies the roles of wife, mother, and prostitute to show how women, instead of transcending through work and creativity, are forced into monotonous existences of having children, tending house and being the sexual receptacles of the male libido.

Because she maintains the existentialist belief in the absolute ontological freedom of each existent regardless of sex, Beauvoir never claims that man has succeeded in destroying woman’s freedom or in actually turning her into an “object” in relation to his subjectivity. She remains a transcendent freedom despite her objectification, alienation and oppression.

Although we certainly can not claim that woman’s role as the Other is her fault, we also cannot say that she is always entirely innocent in her subjection. As taken up in the discussion of The Ethics of Ambiguity, Beauvoir believes that there are many possible attitudes of bad faith where the existent flees his or her responsibility into prefabricated values and beliefs. Many women living in a patriarchal culture are guilty of the same action and thus are in some ways complicitous in their own subjugation because of the seeming benefits it can bring as well as the respite from responsibility it promises. Beauvoir discusses three particular inauthentic attitudes in which women hide their freedom in: “The Narcissist,” “The Woman in Love,” and “The Mystic.” In all three of these attitudes, women deny the original thrust of their freedom by submerging it into the object; in the case of the first, the object is herself, the second, her beloved and the third, the absolute or God.

Beauvoir concludes her work by asserting various concrete demands necessary for woman’s emancipation and the reclamation of her selfhood. First and foremost, she demands that woman be allowed to transcend through her own free projects with all the danger, risk, and uncertainty that entails. As such, modern woman “prides herself on thinking, taking action, working, creating, on the same terms as men; instead of seeking to disparage them, she declares herself their equal.” In order to ensure woman’s equality, Beauvoir advocates such changes in social structures such as universal childcare, equal education, contraception, and legal abortion for women-and perhaps most importantly, woman’s economic freedom and independence from man. In order to achieve this kind of independence, Beauvoir believes that women will benefit from non-alienating, non-exploitative productive labor to some degree. In other words, Beauvoir believes that women will benefit tremendously from work. As far as marriage is concerned, the nuclear family is damaging to both partners, especially the woman. Marriage, like any other authentic choice, must be chosen actively and at all times or else it is a flight from freedom into a static institution.

Beauvoir’s emphasis on the fact that women need access to the same kinds of activities and projects as men places her to some extent in the tradition of liberal, or second-wave feminism. She demands that women be treated as equal to men and laws, customs and education must be altered to encourage this. However, The Second Sex always maintains its fundamental existentialist belief that each individual, regardless of sex, class or age, should be encouraged to define him or herself and to take on the individual responsibility that comes with freedom. This requires not just focusing on universal institutions, but on the situated individual existent struggling within the ambiguity of existence.

4. Literature

a. Novels

In her autobiographies, Beauvoir often makes the claim that although her passion for philosophy was lifelong, her heart was always set on becoming an author of great literature. What she succeeded in doing was writing some of the best existentialist literature of the 20th century. Much as Camus and Sartre discovered, existentialism’s concern for the individual thrown into an absurd world and forced to act, lends itself well to the artistic medium of fiction. All of Beauvoir’s novels incorporate existential themes, problems, and questions in her attempt to describe the human situation in times of personal turmoil, political upheaval, and social unrest.

Her first novel, L’Invitée (She Came to Stay) was published in 1943. Opening with a quote from Hegel about the desire of self-consciousness to seek the death of the other, the book is a complex psychological study of the battles waged for selfhood. Set during the buildup to World War II, it charts the complexity of war in individual relationships. The protagonist, Françoise is forced to undergo the realization that she is not the center of the world and that her relationship to her lover, Pierre is not guaranteed but must, like all relationships, be constantly chosen and won. This work brought her recognition and lead to the writing of one of her most critically acclaimed novels, Le Sang des Autres (The Blood of Others) in 1945. This work begins to take into account the social responsibility that one’s times demand. Set during the German Occupation of France, it follows the lives of the Patriot leader, Jean Blomart and his agony over sending his lover to her death. This work was heralded as one of the leading existential novels of the Resistance and stands as a testimony to the often tragic contradiction between the responsibility we have to ourselves, to those we love, and to our people and humanity as a whole.

In 1946, Beauvoir published Tous les Hommes sont Mortels (All Men are Mortal) which revolves around the question of mortality and immortality. When an aspiring actress discovers that a mysterious and morose man is immortal, she becomes obsessed with her own immortality which she believes will be carried forth by him into eternity after her death. Although this work was not as well-received by critics and the public, it is especially provocative with the phenomena of time and mortality and the desire all human beings share to achieve immortality in any form we can, and how this leads to a denial of lived experience in the here and now.

Les Mandarins (The Mandarins), Beauvoir’s most famous and critically acclaimed novel was published in 1954 and soon thereafter won the prestigious French award for literature, the Prix Goncourt. This work is a profound study of the responsibilities that the intellectual has to his or her society. It explores the virtues and pitfalls of philosophy, journalism, theater, and literature as these media try to speak to their age and to implement social change. The Mandarins brings in a number of Beauvoir’s own personal concerns as it tarries with the issues of Communism and Socialism, the fears of American imperialism and the nuclear bomb, and the relationship of the individual intellectual to other individuals and to society. It also raises the questions of personal and political allegiance and how the two often conflict with tragic results. Finally, Beauvoir’s novel, Les Belles Images (1966), explores the constellation of relationships, hypocrisy and social mores in Parisian society.

b. Short Stories

Beauvoir wrote two collections of short stories. The first, Quand Prime le Spirituel (When Things of the Spirit Come First) wasn’t published until 1979 even though it was her first work of fiction submitted (and rejected) for publication (in 1937). As the 1930’s were less amenable to both women writers and stories on women, it is not so peculiar that this collection was rejected only to be rediscovered and esteemed over forty years later. This work offers fascinating insight into Beauvoir’s concerns with women and their unique attitudes and situations long before the writing of The Second Sex. Divided into five chapters, each titled by the name of the main female character, it exposes the hypocrisy of the French upper classes who hide their self-interests behind a veil of intellectual or religious absolutes. The stories take up the issues of the crushing demands of religious piety and individual renunciation, the tendency to aggrandize our lives to others and the crisis of identity when we are forced to confront our deceptions, and the difficulty of being a woman submitted to bourgeois and religious education and expectations. Beauvoir’s second collection of short stories, La Femme Rompue (The Woman Destroyed), was published in 1967 and was considerably well-received. This too offers separate studies of three women, each of whom is living in bad faith in one form or another. As each encounters a crisis in her familial relationships, she engages in a flight from her responsibility and freedom. This collection expands upon themes found in her ethics and feminism of the often denied complicity in one’s own undoing.

c. Theater

Beauvoir only wrote one play, Les Bouches Inutiles (Who Shall Die?) which was performed in 1945-the same year of the founding of Les Temps Modernes. Clearly enmeshed in the issues of World War II Europe, the dilemma of this play focuses on who is worth sacrificing for the benefit of the collective. This piece was influenced by the history of 14th century Italian towns that, when under siege and facing mass starvation, threw out the old, sick, weak, women and children to fend for themselves so that there might be enough for the strong men to hold out a little longer. The play is set in just such circumstances which were hauntingly resonant to Nazi occupied France. True to Beauvoir’s ethical commitments which assert the freedom and sanctity of the individual only within the freedom and respect of his or her community, the town decides to rise up together and either defeat the enemy or to die together. Although the play contains a number of important and well-developed existential, ethical and feminist themes, it was not as successful as her other literary expressions. Although she never again wrote for the theater, many of the characters of her novels (for example in She Came to Stay, All Men are Mortal, and The Mandarins) are playwrights and actors, showing her confidence in the theatrical arts to convey crucial existential and socio-political dilemmas.

5. Cultural Studies

a. Travel Observations

Beauvoir was always passionate about traveling and embarked upon many adventures both alone and with Sartre and others. Two trips had a tremendous impact upon her and were the impetus for two major books. The first, L’Amérique au Jour le Jour (America Day by Day) was published in 1948, the year after her lecture tour of the United States in 1947. During this visit, she spent time with Richard and Ellen Wright, met Nelson Algren, and visited numerous American cities such as New York, Chicago, Hollywood, Las Vegas, New Orleans and San Antonio. During her stay, she was commissioned by the New York Times to write an article entitled, “An Existentialist Looks at Americans,” appearing on May 25, 1947. It offers a penetrating critique of the United States as a country so full of promise but also one that is a slave to novelty, material culture, and a pathological fixation on the present at the expense of the past. Such themes are repeated in greater detail in America Day by Day, which also tackles the issue of America’s strained race relations, imperialism, anti-intellectualism, and class tensions.

The second major work to come out of Beauvoir’s travels resulted from her two-month trip to China with Sartre in 1955. Published in 1957, La Longue Marche (The Long March) is a generally positive account of the vast Communist country. Although disturbed by the censorship and careful choreographing of their visit by the Communists, she found China to be working towards a betterment in the life of its people. The themes of labor and the plight of the worker are common throughout this work, as is the situation of women and the family. Despite the breadth of its investigation and the desire on Beauvoir’s behalf to study a completely foreign culture, it was both a critical and a personal embarrassment. She later admitted that it was done more to make money than to offer a serious cultural analysis of China and its people. Regardless of these somewhat justified criticisms, it stands as interesting exploration of the tension between capitalism and Communism, the self and its other, and what it means to be free in different cultural contexts.

b. The Coming of Age

In 1967, Beauvoir began a monumental study of the same genre and caliber as The Second Sex. La Vieillesse (The Coming of Age, 1970) met with instant critical success. The Second Sex had been received with considerable hostility from many groups who did not want to be confronted with an unpleasant critique of their sexist and oppressive attitudes towards women; The Coming of Age however, was generally welcomed although it too critiques society’s prejudices towards another oppressed group: the elderly. This masterful work takes the fear of age as a cultural phenomenon and seeks to give voice to a silenced and detested class of human beings. Lashing out against the injustices suffered by the old, Beauvoir successfully complicates a problem all too oversimplified. For example, she notes that, depending on one’s work or class, old age can come earlier or later. Those who are materially more advantaged can afford good medicine, food and exercise, and thus live much longer and age less quickly, than a miner who is old at 50. In addition, she notices the philosophically complex connection between age and poverty and age and dehumanization.

As she had done in with The Second Sex, Beauvoir approaches the subject matter of The Coming of Age from a variety of perspectives including the biological, anthropological, historical, and sociological. In addition, she explores the question of age from the perspective of the living, elderly human being in relation to his or her body, time and the external world. Just as with The Second Sex, this later work is divided into two books, the first which deals with “Old Age as Seen from Without” and the second with, “Being-in-the-World.” Beauvoir explains the motivation for this division in her Introduction where she writes, “Every human situation can be viewed from without-seen from the point of view of an outsider-or from within, in so far as the subject assumes and at the same time transcends it.” Continuing to uphold her belief in the fundamental ambiguity of existence which always sits atop the contradiction of immanence and transcendence, objectivity and subjectivity, Beauvoir treats the subject of age both as an object of cultural-historical knowledge and as the first-hand, lived experience of aged individuals.

What she concludes from her investigation into the experience, fear and stigma of old age is that even though the process of aging and the decline into death is an inescapable, existential phenomenon for those human beings who live long enough to experience it, there is no necessity to our loathing the aged members of society. There is a certain acceptance of the fear of age felt by most people because it ironically stands as more of the opposite to life than does death. However, this does not demand that the aged merely resign themselves to waiting for death or for younger members of society to treat them as the invisible class. Rather, Beauvoir argues in true existentialist fashion that old age must still be a time of creative and meaningful projects and relationships with others. This means that above all else, old age must not be a time of boredom, but a time of continuous political and social action. This requires a change of orientation among the aged themselves and within society as a whole which must transform its idea that a person is only valuable insofar as they are profitable. Instead, both individuals and society must recognize that a person’s value lies in his or her humanity which is unaffected by age.

c. Autobiographical Works

In her autobiography, Beauvoir tells us that in wanting to write about herself she had to first explain what it meant to be a woman and that this realization was the genesis of The Second Sex. However, Beauvoir also successfully embarked upon the recounting of her life in four volumes of detailed and philosophically rich autobiography. In addition to painting a vibrant picture of her own life, Beauvoir also gives us access into other influential figures of the 20th century ranging from Camus, Sartre and Merleau-Ponty, to Richard Wright, Jean Cocteau, Jean Genet, Antonin Artaud and Fidel Castro among many others. Even though her autobiography covers both non-philosophical and philosophical ground, it is important not to downplay the role that autobiography has in Beauvoir’s theoretical development. Indeed, many other existentialists, such as Nietzsche, Sartre, and Kierkegaard, embrace the autobiographical as a key component to the philosophical. Beauvoir always maintained the importance of the individual’s situation and experience in the face of contingency and the ambiguity of existence. Through the recounting of her life, we are given a unique and personal picture of Beauvoir’s struggles as a philosopher, social reformer, writer and woman during a time of great cultural and artistic achievement and political upheaval.

The first volume of her autobiography, Mémoirs d’une Jeune Fille Rangée (Memoirs of a Dutiful Daughter, 1958), traces Beauvoir’s childhood, her relationship with her parents, her profound friendship with Zaza and her schooling up through her years at the Sorbonne. In this volume, Beauvoir shows the development of her intellectual and independent personality and the influences which lead to her decisions to become a philosopher and a writer. It also presents a picture of a woman who was critical of her class and its expectations of women from an early age. The second volume of her autobiography, La Force de l’Âge (The Prime of Life, 1960) is often considered to be the richest of all the volumes. Like Memoirs of a Dutiful Daughter, it was commercially and critically well received. Taking up the years from 1929-1944, Beauvoir portrays her transition from student to adult and the discovery of personal responsibility in war and peace. In many points, she explores the motivations for many of her works, such as The Second Sex and The Mandarins. The third installment of her autobiography, La Force des Choses (The Force of Circumstance, 1963; published in two separate volumes) takes up the time frame following the conclusion of World War II in1944 to the year 1962. In these volumes, Beauvoir becomes increasingly more aware of the political responsibility of the intellectual to his or her country and times. In the volume between 1944-1952 (After the War) Beauvoir describes the intellectual blossoming of post-war Paris, rich with anecdotes on writers, filmmakers and artists. The volume focusing on the decade between 1952-1962 (Hard Times), shows a much more subdued and somewhat cynical Beauvoir who is coming to terms with fame, age and the political atrocities waged by France in its war with Algeria (taken up in her work with Gisèle Halimi and the case of Djamila Boupacha). Because of its brutal honesty on the themes of aging, death and war, this volume of her autobiography was less well-received than the previous two. The final installment in the chronicling of her life charts the years from 1962-1972. Tout Compte Fait, (All Said and Done, 1972) shows an older and wiser philosopher and feminist who looks back over her life, her relationships, and her accomplishments and recognizes that it was all for the best. Here Beauvoir shows her commitments to feminism and social change in a clarity only hinted at in earlier volumes and she continues to struggle with the virtues and pitfalls of capitalism and Communism. Additionally, she returns to past works such as The Second Sex, to reevaluate her motivations and her conclusions about literature, philosophy, and the act of remembering. She again returns to the themes of death and dying and their existential significance as she begins to experience the passing of those she loves.

Although not exactly considered to be “autobiography,” it is worth mentioning two more facets of Beauvoir’s self-revelatory literature. The first consists of her works on the lives and deaths of loved ones. In this area, we find her sensitive and personal recounting of her mother’s death in Une Mort très Douce (A Very Easy Death, 1964). This book is often considered to be one of Beauvoir’s best in its day-by-day portrayal of the ambiguity of love and the experience of loss. In 1981, following the death of Sartre the previous year, she published La Cérémonie des Adieux (Adieux: A Farewell to Sartre) which recounts the progression of an aged and infirm Sartre to his death. This work was somewhat controversial as many readers missed its qualities as a tribute to the late, great philosopher and instead considered it to be an inappropriate exposé on his illness.

The second facet of Beauvoir’s life that can be considered autobiographical are the publication by Beauvoir of Sartre’s letters to her in Lettres au Castor et à Quelques Autres (Letters to Castor and Others, 1983) and of her own correspondence with Sartre in Letters to Sartre published after her death in 1990. Finally, A Transatlantic Love Affair, compiled by Sylvie le Bon de Beauvoir in 1997 and published in 1998, presents Beauvoir’s letters (originally written in English) to Nelson Algren. Each of these works provides us with another perspective into the life of one of the most powerful philosophers of the 20th century and one of the most influential female intellectuals on the history of Western thinking.

6. References and Further Reading

a. Selected Works by Beauvoir (in French and English)

• Beauvoir, Simone de. Adieux: A Farewell to Sartre. Translated by Patrick O’Brian. Harmondsworth: Penguin, 1986. English translation of La cérémonie des adieux (Paris: Gallimard, 1981).
• Beauvoir, Simone de. All Men are Mortal. Translated by Leonard M. Friedman. New York: W. W. Norton & Co., 1992. English translation of Tous les Hommes sont Mortels (Paris: Gallimard, 1946).
• Beauvoir, Simone de. All Said and Done. Translated by Patrick O’Brian. New York: Paragon House, 1993. English translation of Tout compte fait (Paris: Gallimard, 1972).
• Beauvoir, Simone de. America Day by Day. Translated by Carol Cosman. Berkeley: University of California Press, 1990. English translation of L’Amérique au jour le jour (Paris: Gallimard, 1954).
• Beauvoir, Simone de. Sons & Co. Ltd., 1968. English translation of Les belles images (Paris: Gallimard, 1966).
• Beauvoir, Simone de. The Blood of Others. Translated by Roger Senhouse and Yvonne Moyse. New York: Pantheon Books, 1948. English translation of Le sang des autres (Paris: Gallimard, 1945).
• Beauvoir, Simone de. The Coming of Age. Translated by Patrick O’Brian. New York: W. W. Norton & Company, 1996. English translation of La vieillesse (Paris: Gallimard, 1970).
• Beauvoir, Simone de. “In Defense of Djamila Boupacha.” Le Monde, 3 June, 1960. Appendix B in Djamila Boupacha: The Story of the Torture of a Young Algerian Girl which Shocked Liberal French Opinion; Introduction to Djamila Boupacha. Edited by Simone de Beauvoir and Gisèle Halimi. Translated by Peter Green. New York: The Macmillan Company, 1962. English translations of Djamila Boupacha (Paris: Gallimard, 1962).
• Beauvoir, Simone de. The Ethics of Ambiguity. Translated by Bernard Frechtman. New York: Citadel Press, 1996. English translation of Pour une morale de l’ambiguïté (Paris: Gallimard, 1947). Beauvoir, Simone de Beauvoir, Simone de. Force of Circumstance, Vol. I: After the War, 1944-1952; Vol. 2: Hard Times, 1952-1962. Translated by Richard Howard. New York: Paragon House, 1992. English translation of La force des choses (Paris: Gallimard, 1963).
• Beauvoir, Simone de. Letters to Sartre. Translated and Edited by Quintin Hoare. London: Vintage, 1992. English translation of Lettres à Sartre (Paris: Gallimard, 1990).
• Beauvoir, Simone de. The Long March. Translated by Austryn Wainhouse. New York: The World Publishing, 1958. English translation of La longue marche (Paris: Gallimard, 1957).
• Beauvoir, Simone de. The Mandarins. Translated by Leonard M. Friedman. New York: W. W. Norton & Co., 1991. English translation of Les mandarins (Paris: Gallimard, 1954).
• Beauvoir, Simone de. Memoirs of a Dutiful Daughter. Translated by James Kirkup. Middlesex: Penguin Books, 1963. English translation of Mémoires d’une jeune fille rangée (Paris: Gallimard, 1958).
• Beauvoir, Simone de. The Prime of Life. Translated by Peter Green. New York: Lancer Books, 1966. English translation of La force de l’âge (Paris: Gallimard, 1960).
• Beauvoir, Simone de. Pyrrhus et Cinéas. Paris: Gallimard, 1944.
• Beauvoir, Simone de. The Second Sex. Translated by H. M. Parshley. New York: Vintage Books, 1989. English translation of Le deuxième sexe (Paris: Gallimard, 1949).
• Beauvoir, Simone de. Must We Burn Sade? Translated by Annette Michelson, The Marquis de Sade. New York: Grove Press, 1966. English translation of Faut-il brûler Sade? (Paris: Gallimard, 1955).
• Beauvoir, Simone de. She Came to Stay. Translated by Roger Senhouse and Yvonne Moyse. New York: W. W. Norton & Co.,1954. English translation of L’Invitée (Paris: Gallimard, 1943).
• Beauvoir, Simone de. A Transatlantic Love Affair: Letters to Nelson Algren. Compiled and annotated by Sylvie le Bon de Beauvoir. New York: The New Press, 1998.
• Beauvoir, Simone de. A Very Easy Death. Translated by Patrick O’Brian. New York: Pantheon Books, 1965. English translation of Une mort très douce (Paris: Gallimard, 1964).
• Beauvoir, Simone de. When Things of the Spirit Come First. Translated by Patrick O’Brian. New York: Pantheon Books, 1982. English translation of Quand prime le spirituel (Paris: Gallimard, 1979).
• Beauvoir, Simone de. Who Shall Die? Translated by Claude Francis and Fernande Gontier. Florissant: River Press, 1983. English translation of Les bouches inutiles (Paris: Gallimard, 1945).
• Beauvoir, Simone de. The Woman Destroyed. Translated by Patrick O’Brian. New York: Pantheon Books, 1969. English translation of La femme rompue (Paris: Gallimard, 1967).

b. Selected Books on Beauvoir in English

• Arp, Kristana. The Bonds of Freedom. Chicago: Open Court Publishing, 2001.
• Bair, Deirdre. Simone de Beauvoir: A Biography. New York: Summit Books, 1990.
• Bauer, Nancy. Simone de Beauvoir, Philosophy and Feminism. New York: Columbia University Press, 2001.
• Bergoffen, Debra. The Philosophy of Simone de Beauvoir: Gendered Phenomenologies, Erotic Generosities. Albany: SUNY Press, 1997.
• Fallaize, Elizabeth. The Novels of Simone de Beauvoir. London: Routledge, 1988.
• Fullbrook, Kate and Edward. Simone de Beauvoir and Jean-Paul Sartre: The Remaking of a Twentieth-Century Legend. New York: Basic Books: 1994.
• Le Doeuff, Michèle. Hipparchia’s Choice: An Essay Concerning Women, Philosophy, Etc. Translated by Trista Selous. Oxford: Blackwell Publishers, 1991.
• Lundgren-Gothlin, Eva. Sex and Existence: Simone de Beauvoir’s ‘The Second Sex.’ Translated by Linda Schenck. Hanover: Wesleyan University Press, 1996.
• Moi, Toril. Feminist Theory and Simone de Beauvoir. Oxford: Blackwell, 1990.
• Moi, Toril. Simone de Beauvoir: The Making of an Intellectual Woman. Oxford: Blackwell, 1994.
• Okely, Judith. Simone de Beauvoir. New York: Pantheon Books, 1986.
• Scholz, Sally J. On de Beauvoir. Belmont: Wadsworth, 2000.
• Schwarzer, Alice. After the Second Sex: Conversations with Simone de Beauvoir. Translated by Marianne Howarth. New York: Pantheon Books, 1984.
• Simons, Margaret. Beauvoir and the Second Sex: Feminism, Race and the Origins of Existentialism. Lanham: Rowman and Littlefield, 1999.
• Simons, Margaret. ed. Feminist Interpretations of Simone de Beauvoir. University Park: The Pennsylvania State University Press, 1995.
• Vintges, Karen. Philosophy as Passion: The Thinking of Simone de Beauvoir. Translated by Anne Lavelle. Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1996.

Author Information

Shannon Mussett
Email: shannon.mussett@uvu.edu
Utah Valley University
U. S. A.

Jacques Derrida (1930—2004)

Jacques Derrida was one of the most well known twentieth century philosophers. He was also one of the most prolific. Distancing himself from the various philosophical movements and traditions that preceded him on the French intellectual scene (phenomenology, existentialism, and structuralism), he developed a strategy called “deconstruction” in the mid 1960s. Although not purely negative, deconstruction is primarily concerned with something tantamount to a critique of the Western philosophical tradition. Deconstruction is generally presented via an analysis of specific texts. It seeks to expose, and then to subvert, the various binary oppositions that undergird our dominant ways of thinking—presence/absence, speech/writing, and so forth.

Deconstruction has at least two aspects: literary and philosophical. The literary aspect concerns the textual interpretation, where invention is essential to finding hidden alternative meanings in the text. The philosophical aspect concerns the main target of deconstruction: the “metaphysics of presence,” or simply metaphysics. Starting from an Heideggerian point of view, Derrida argues that metaphysics affects the whole of philosophy from Plato onwards. Metaphysics creates dualistic oppositions and installs a hierarchy that unfortunately privileges one term of each dichotomy (presence before absence, speech before writing, and so on).

The deconstructive strategy is to unmask these too-sedimented ways of thinking, and it operates on them especially through two steps—reversing dichotomies and attempting to corrupt the dichotomies themselves. The strategy also aims to show that there are undecidables, that is, something that cannot conform to either side of a dichotomy or opposition. Undecidability returns in later period of Derrida’s reflection, when it is applied to reveal paradoxes involved in notions such as gift giving or hospitality, whose conditions of possibility are at the same time their conditions of impossibility. Because of this, it is undecidable whether authentic giving or hospitality are either possible or impossible.

In this period, the founder of deconstruction turns his attention to ethical themes. In particular, the theme of responsibility to the other (for example, God or a beloved person) leads Derrida to leave the idea that responsibility is associated with a behavior publicly and rationally justifiable by general principles. Reflecting upon tales of Jewish tradition, he highlights the absolute singularity of responsibility to the other.

Deconstruction has had an enormous influence in psychology, literary theory, cultural studies, linguistics, feminism, sociology and anthropology. Poised in the interstices between philosophy and non-philosophy (or philosophy and literature), it is not difficult to see why this is the case. What follows in this article, however, is an attempt to bring out the philosophical significance of Derrida’s thought.

Table of Contents

1. Life and Works
2. Deconstructive Strategy
   1. Metaphysics of Presence/Logocentrism
3. Key terms from the early work
   1. Speech/Writing
   2. Arche-writing
   3. Différance
   4. Trace
   5. Supplement
4. Time and Phenomenology
5. Undecidability
   1. Decision
6. The Other
   1. Responsibility to the Other
   2. Wholly Other/Messianic
7. Possible and Impossible Aporias
   1. The Gift
   2. Hospitality
   3. Forgiveness
   4. Mourning
8. References and Further Reading
   1. Derrida’s Texts (and Their Abbreviations)
   2. Selected Commentaries

1. Life and Works

In 1930, Derrida was born into a Jewish family in Algiers. He was also born into an environment of some discrimination. In fact, he either withdrew from, or was forced out of at least two schools during his childhood simply on account of being Jewish. He was expelled from one school because there was a 7% limit on the Jewish population, and he later withdrew from another school on account of the anti-semitism. While Derrida would resist any reductive understanding of his work based upon his biographical life, it could be argued that these kind of experiences played a large role in his insistence upon the importance of the marginal, and the other, in his later thought.

Derrida was twice refused a position in the prestigious Ecole Normale Superieure (where Sartre, Simone de Beauvoir and the majority of French intellectuals and academics began their careers), but he was eventually accepted to the institution at the age of 19. He hence moved from Algiers to France, and soon after he also began to play a major role in the leftist journal Tel Quel. Derrida’s initial work in philosophy was largely phenomenological, and his early training as a philosopher was done largely through the lens of Husserl. Other important inspirations on his early thought include Nietzsche, Heidegger, Saussure, Levinas and Freud. Derrida acknowledges his indebtedness to all of these thinkers in the development of his approach to texts, which has come to be known as ‘deconstruction’.

It was in 1967 that Derrida really arrived as a philosopher of world importance. He published three momentous texts (Of Grammatology, Writing and Difference, and Speech and Phenomena). All of these works have been influential for different reasons, but it is Of Grammatology that remains his most famous work (it is analysed in some detail in this article). In Of Grammatology, Derrida reveals and then undermines the speech-writing opposition that he argues has been such an influential factor in Western thought. His preoccupation with language in this text is typical of much of his early work, and since the publication of these and other major texts (including Dissemination, Glas, The Postcard, Spectres of Marx, The Gift of Death, and Politics of Friendship), deconstruction has gradually moved from occupying a major role in continental Europe, to also becoming a significant player in the Anglo-American philosophical context. This is particularly so in the areas of literary criticism, and cultural studies, where deconstruction’s method of textual analysis has inspired theorists like Paul de Man. He has also had lecturing positions at various universities, the world over. Derrida died in 2004.

Deconstruction has frequently been the subject of some controversy. When Derrida was awarded an honorary doctorate at Cambridge in 1992, there were howls of protest from many ‘analytic’ philosophers. Since then, Derrida has also had many dialogues with philosophers like John Searle (see Limited Inc.), in which deconstruction has been roundly criticised, although perhaps unfairly at times. However, what is clear from the antipathy of such thinkers is that deconstruction challenges traditional philosophy in several important ways, and the remainder of this article will highlight why this is so.

2. Deconstructive Strategy

Derrida, like many other contemporary European theorists, is preoccupied with undermining the oppositional tendencies that have befallen much of the Western philosophical tradition. In fact, dualisms are the staple diet of deconstruction, for without these hierarchies and orders of subordination it would be left with nowhere to intervene. Deconstruction is parasitic in that rather than espousing yet another grand narrative, or theory about the nature of the world in which we partake, it restricts itself to distorting already existing narratives, and to revealing the dualistic hierarchies they conceal. While Derrida’s claims to being someone who speaks solely in the margins of philosophy can be contested, it is important to take these claims into account. Deconstruction is, somewhat infamously, the philosophy that says nothing. To the extent that it can be suggested that Derrida’s concerns are often philosophical, they are clearly not phenomenological (he assures us that his work is to be read specifically against Husserl, Sartre and Merleau-Ponty) and nor are they ontological.

Deconstruction, and particularly early deconstruction, functions by engaging in sustained analyses of particular texts. It is committed to the rigorous analysis of the literal meaning of a text, and yet also to finding within that meaning, perhaps in the neglected corners of the text (including the footnotes), internal problems that actually point towards alternative meanings. Deconstruction must hence establish a methodology that pays close attention to these apparently contradictory imperatives (sameness and difference) and a reading of any Derridean text can only reaffirm this dual aspect. Derrida speaks of the first aspect of this deconstructive strategy as being akin to a fidelity and a “desire to be faithful to the themes and audacities of a thinking” (WD 84). At the same time, however, deconstruction also famously borrows from Martin Heidegger’s conception of a ‘destructive retrieve’ and seeks to open texts up to alternative and usually repressed meanings that reside at least partly outside of the metaphysical tradition (although always also partly betrothed to it). This more violent and transgressive aspect of deconstruction is illustrated by Derrida’s consistent exhortation to “invent in your own language if you can or want to hear mine; invent if you can or want to give my language to be understood” (MO 57). In suggesting that a faithful interpretation of him is one that goes beyond him, Derrida installs invention as a vitally important aspect of any deconstructive reading. He is prone to making enigmatic suggestions like “go there where you cannot go, to the impossible, it is indeed the only way of coming or going” (ON 75), and ultimately, the merit of a deconstructive reading consists in this creative contact with another text that cannot be characterised as either mere fidelity or as an absolute transgression, but rather which oscillates between these dual demands. The intriguing thing about deconstruction, however, is that despite the fact that Derrida’s own interpretations of specific texts are quite radical, it is often difficult to pinpoint where the explanatory exegesis of a text ends and where the more violent aspect of deconstruction begins. Derrida is always reluctant to impose ‘my text’, ‘your text’ designations too conspicuously in his texts. This is partly because it is even problematic to speak of a ‘work’ of deconstruction, since deconstruction only highlights what was already revealed in the text itself. All of the elements of a deconstructive intervention reside in the “neglected cornerstones” of an already existing system (MDM 72), and this equation is not altered in any significant way whether that ‘system’ be conceived of as metaphysics generally, which must contain its non-metaphysical track, or the writings of a specific thinker, which must also always testify to that which they are attempting to exclude (MDM 73).

These are, of course, themes reflected upon at length by Derrida, and they have an immediate consequence on the meta-theoretical level. To the minimal extent that we can refer to Derrida’s own arguments, it must be recognised that they are always intertwined with the arguments of whomever, or whatever, he seeks to deconstruct. For example, Derrida argues that his critique of the Husserlian ‘now’ moment is actually based upon resources within Husserl’s own text which elide the self-presence that he was attempting to secure (SP 64-66). If Derrida’s point is simply that Husserl’s phenomenology holds within itself conclusions that Husserl failed to recognise, Derrida seems to be able to disavow any transcendental or ontological position. This is why he argues that his work occupies a place in the margins of philosophy, rather than simply being philosophy per se.

Deconstruction contends that in any text, there are inevitably points of equivocation and ‘undecidability’ that betray any stable meaning that an author might seek to impose upon his or her text. The process of writing always reveals that which has been suppressed, covers over that which has been disclosed, and more generally breaches the very oppositions that are thought to sustain it. This is why Derrida’s ‘philosophy’ is so textually based and it is also why his key terms are always changing, because depending upon who or what he is seeking to deconstruct, that point of equivocation will always be located in a different place.

This also ensures that any attempt to describe what deconstruction is, must be careful. Nothing would be more antithetical to deconstruction’s stated intent than this attempt at defining it through the decidedly metaphysical question “what is deconstruction?” There is a paradoxicality involved in trying to restrict deconstruction to one particular and overarching purpose (OG 19) when it is predicated upon the desire to expose us to that which is wholly other (tout autre) and to open us up to alternative possibilities. At times, this exegesis will run the risk of ignoring the many meanings of Derridean deconstruction, and the widely acknowledged difference between Derrida’s early and late work is merely the most obvious example of the difficulties involved in suggesting “deconstruction says this”, or “deconstruction prohibits that”.

That said, certain defining features of deconstruction can be noticed. For example, Derrida’s entire enterprise is predicated upon the conviction that dualisms are irrevocably present in the various philosophers and artisans that he considers. While some philosophers argue that he is a little reductive when he talks about the Western philosophical tradition, it is his understanding of this tradition that informs and provides the tools for a deconstructive response. Because of this, it is worth briefly considering the target of Derridean deconstruction – the metaphysics of presence, or somewhat synonymously, logocentrism.

a. Metaphysics of Presence/Logocentrism

There are many different terms that Derrida employs to describe what he considers to be the fundamental way(s) of thinking of the Western philosophical tradition. These include: logocentrism, phallogocentrism, and perhaps most famously, the metaphysics of presence, but also often simply ‘metaphysics’. These terms all have slightly different meanings. Logocentrism emphasises the privileged role that logos, or speech, has been accorded in the Western tradition (see Section 3). Phallogocentrism points towards the patriarchal significance of this privileging. Derrida’s enduring references to the metaphysics of presence borrows heavily from the work of Heidegger. Heidegger insists that Western philosophy has consistently privileged that which is, or that which appears, and has forgotten to pay any attention to the condition for that appearance. In other words, presence itself is privileged, rather than that which allows presence to be possible at all – and also impossible, for Derrida (see Section 4, for more on the metaphysics of presence). All of these terms of denigration, however, are united under the broad rubric of the term ‘metaphysics’. What, then, does Derrida mean by metaphysics?

In the ‘Afterword’ to Limited Inc., Derrida suggests that metaphysics can be defined as:

“The enterprise of returning ‘strategically’, ‘ideally’, to an origin or to a priority thought to be simple, intact, normal, pure, standard, self-identical, in order then to think in terms of derivation, complication, deterioration, accident, etc. All metaphysicians, from Plato to Rousseau, Descartes to Husserl, have proceeded in this way, conceiving good to be before evil, the positive before the negative, the pure before the impure, the simple before the complex, the essential before the accidental, the imitated before the imitation, etc. And this is not just one metaphysical gesture among others, it is the metaphysical exigency, that which has been the most constant, most profound and most potent” (LI 236).

According to Derrida then, metaphysics involves installing hierarchies and orders of subordination in the various dualisms that it encounters (M 195). Moreover, metaphysical thought prioritises presence and purity at the expense of the contingent and the complicated, which are considered to be merely aberrations that are not important for philosophical analysis. Basically then, metaphysical thought always privileges one side of an opposition, and ignores or marginalises the alternative term of that opposition.

In another attempt to explain deconstruction’s treatment of, and interest in oppositions, Derrida has suggested that: “An opposition of metaphysical concepts (speech/writing, presence/absence, etc.) is never the face-to-face of two terms, but a hierarchy and an order of subordination. Deconstruction cannot limit itself or proceed immediately to neutralisation: it must, by means of a double gesture, a double science, a double writing, practise an overturning of the classical opposition, and a general displacement of the system. It is on that condition alone that deconstruction will provide the means of intervening in the field of oppositions it criticises” (M 195). In order to better understand this dual ‘methodology’ – that is also the deconstruction of the notion of a methodology because it no longer believes in the possibility of an observer being absolutely exterior to the object/text being examined – it is helpful to consider an example of this deconstruction at work (See Speech/Writing below).

3. Key terms from the early work

Derrida’s terms change in every text that he writes. This is part of his deconstructive strategy. He focuses on particular themes or words in a text, which on account of their ambiguity undermine the more explicit intention of that text. It is not possible for all of these to be addressed (Derrida has published in the vicinity of 60 texts in English), so this article focused on some of the most pivotal terms and neologisms from his early thought. It addresses aspects of his later, more theme-based thought, in Sections 6 & 7.

a. Speech/Writing

The most prominent opposition with which Derrida’s earlier work is concerned is that between speech and writing. According to Derrida, thinkers as different as Plato, Rousseau, Saussure, and Levi-Strauss, have all denigrated the written word and valorised speech, by contrast, as some type of pure conduit of meaning. Their argument is that while spoken words are the symbols of mental experience, written words are the symbols of that already existing symbol. As representations of speech, they are doubly derivative and doubly far from a unity with one’s own thought. Without going into detail regarding the ways in which these thinkers have set about justifying this type of hierarchical opposition, it is important to remember that the first strategy of deconstruction is to reverse existing oppositions. In Of Grammatology (perhaps his most famous work), Derrida hence attempts to illustrate that the structure of writing and grammatology are more important and even ‘older’ than the supposedly pure structure of presence-to-self that is characterised as typical of speech.

For example, in an entire chapter of his Course in General Linguistics, Ferdinand de Saussure tries to restrict the science of linguistics to the phonetic and audible word only (24). In the course of his inquiry, Saussure goes as far as to argue that “language and writing are two distinct systems of signs: the second exists for the sole purpose of representing the first”. Language, Saussure insists, has an oral tradition that is independent of writing, and it is this independence that makes a pure science of speech possible. Derrida vehemently disagrees with this hierarchy and instead argues that all that can be claimed of writing – eg. that it is derivative and merely refers to other signs – is equally true of speech. But as well as criticising such a position for certain unjustifiable presuppositions, including the idea that we are self-identical with ourselves in ‘hearing’ ourselves think, Derrida also makes explicit the manner in which such a hierarchy is rendered untenable from within Saussure’s own text. Most famously, Saussure is the proponent of the thesis that is commonly referred to as “the arbitrariness of the sign”, and this asserts, to simplify matters considerably, that the signifier bears no necessary relationship to that which is signified. Saussure derives numerous consequences from this position, but as Derrida points out, this notion of arbitrariness and of “unmotivated institutions” of signs, would seem to deny the possibility of any natural attachment (OG 44). After all, if the sign is arbitrary and eschews any foundational reference to reality, it would seem that a certain type of sign (ie. the spoken) could not be more natural than another (ie. the written). However, it is precisely this idea of a natural attachment that Saussure relies upon to argue for our “natural bond” with sound (25), and his suggestion that sounds are more intimately related to our thoughts than the written word hence runs counter to his fundamental principle regarding the arbitrariness of the sign.

b. Arche-writing

In Of Grammatology and elsewhere, Derrida argues that signification, broadly conceived, always refers to other signs, and that one can never reach a sign that refers only to itself. He suggests that “writing is not a sign of a sign, except if one says it of all signs, which would be more profoundly true” (OG 43), and this process of infinite referral, of never arriving at meaning itself, is the notion of ‘writing’ that he wants to emphasise. This is not writing narrowly conceived, as in a literal inscription upon a page, but what he terms ‘arche-writing’. Arche-writing refers to a more generalised notion of writing that insists that the breach that the written introduces between what is intended to be conveyed and what is actually conveyed, is typical of an originary breach that afflicts everything one might wish to keep sacrosanct, including the notion of self-presence.

This originary breach that arche-writing refers to can be separated out to reveal two claims regarding spatial differing and temporal deferring. To explicate the first of these claims, Derrida’s emphasis upon how writing differs from itself is simply to suggest that writing, and by extension all repetition, is split (differed) by the absence that makes it necessary. One example of this might be that we write something down because we may soon forget it, or to communicate something to someone who is not with us. According to Derrida, all writing, in order to be what it is, must be able to function in the absence of every empirically determined addressee (M 375). Derrida also considers deferral to be typical of the written and this is to reinforce that the meaning of a certain text is never present, never entirely captured by a critic’s attempt to pin it down. The meaning of a text is constantly subject to the whims of the future, but when that so-called future is itself ‘present’ (if we try and circumscribe the future by reference to a specific date or event) its meaning is equally not realised, but subject to yet another future that can also never be present. The key to a text is never even present to the author themselves, for the written always defers its meaning. As a consequence we cannot simply ask Derrida to explain exactly what he meant by propounding that enigmatic sentiment that has been translated as “there is nothing outside of the text” (OG 158). Any explanatory words that Derrida may offer would themselves require further explanation. [That said, it needs to be emphasised that Derrida’s point is not so much that everything is simply semiotic or linguistic – as this is something that he explicitly denies – but that the processes of differing and deferring found within linguistic representation are symptomatic of a more general situation that afflicts everything, including the body and the perceptual]. So, Derrida’s more generalised notion of writing, arche-writing, refers to the way in which the written is possible only on account of this ‘originary’ deferral of meaning that ensures that meaning can never be definitively present. In conjunction with the differing aspect that we have already seen him associate with, and then extend beyond the traditional confines of writing, he will come to describe these two overlapping processes via that most famous of neologisms: différance.

c. Différance

Différance is an attempt to conjoin the differing and deferring aspects involved in arche-writing in a term that itself plays upon the distinction between the audible and the written. After all, what differentiates différance and différence is inaudible, and this means that distinguishing between them actually requires the written. This problematises efforts like Saussure’s, which as well as attempting to keep speech and writing apart, also suggest that writing is an almost unnecessary addition to speech. In response to such a claim, Derrida can simply point out that there is often, and perhaps even always, this type of ambiguity in the spoken word – différence as compared to différance – that demands reference to the written. If the spoken word requires the written to function properly, then the spoken is itself always at a distance from any supposed clarity of consciousness. It is this originary breach that Derrida associates with the terms arche-writing and différance.

Of course, différance cannot be exhaustively defined, and this is largely because of Derrida’s insistence that it is “neither a word, nor a concept”, as well as the fact that the meaning of the term changes depending upon the particular context in which it is being employed. For the moment, however, it suffices to suggest that according to Derrida, différance is typical of what is involved in arche-writing and this generalised notion of writing that breaks down the entire logic of the sign (OG 7). The widespread conviction that the sign literally represents something, which even if not actually present, could be potentially present, is rendered impossible by arche-writing, which insists that signs always refer to yet more signs ad infinitum, and that there is no ultimate referent or foundation. This reversal of the subordinated term of an opposition accomplishes the first of deconstruction’s dual strategic intents. Rather than being criticised for being derivative or secondary, for Derrida, writing, or at least the processes that characterise writing (ie. différance and arche-writing), are ubiquitous. Just as a piece of writing has no self-present subject to explain what every particular word means (and this ensures that what is written must partly elude any individual’s attempt to control it), this is equally typical of the spoken. Utilising the same structure of repetition, nothing guarantees that another person will endow the words I use with the particular meaning that I attribute to them. Even the conception of an internal monologue and the idea that we can intimately ‘hear’ our own thoughts in a non-contingent way is misguided, as it ignores the way that arche-writing privileges difference and a non-coincidence with oneself (SP 60-70).

d. Trace

In this respect, it needs to be pointed out that all of deconstruction’s reversals (arche-writing included) are partly captured by the edifice that they seek to overthrow. For Derrida, “one always inhabits, and all the more when one does not suspect it” (OG 24), and it is important to recognise that the mere reversal of an existing metaphysical opposition might not also challenge the governing framework and presuppositions that are attempting to be reversed (WD 280). Deconstruction hence cannot rest content with merely prioritising writing over speech, but must also accomplish the second major aspect of deconstruction’s dual strategies, that being to corrupt and contaminate the opposition itself.

Derrida must highlight that the categories that sustain and safeguard any dualism are always already disrupted and displaced. To effect this second aspect of deconstruction’s strategic intents, Derrida usually coins a new term, or reworks an old one, to permanently disrupt the structure into which he has intervened – examples of this include his discussion of the pharmakon in Plato (drug or tincture, salutary or maleficent), and the supplement in Rousseau, which will be considered towards the end of this section. To phrase the problem in slightly different terms, Derrida’s argument is that in examining a binary opposition, deconstruction manages to expose a trace. This is not a trace of the oppositions that have since been deconstructed – on the contrary, the trace is a rupture within metaphysics, a pattern of incongruities where the metaphysical rubs up against the non-metaphysical, that it is deconstruction’s job to juxtapose as best as it can. The trace does not appear as such (OG 65), but the logic of its path in a text can be mimed by a deconstructive intervention and hence brought to the fore.

e. Supplement

The logic of the supplement is also an important aspect of Of Grammatology. A supplement is something that, allegedly secondarily, comes to serve as an aid to something ‘original’ or ‘natural’. Writing is itself an example of this structure, for as Derrida points out, “if supplementarity is a necessarily indefinite process, writing is the supplement par excellence since it proposes itself as the supplement of the supplement, sign of a sign, taking the place of a speech already significant” (OG 281). Another example of the supplement might be masturbation, as Derrida suggests (OG 153), or even the use of birth control precautions. What is notable about both of these examples is an ambiguity that ensures that what is supplementary can always be interpreted in two ways. For example, our society’s use of birth control precautions might be interpreted as suggesting that our natural way is lacking and that the contraceptive pill, or condom, etc., hence replaces a fault in nature. On the other hand, it might also be argued that such precautions merely add on to, and enrich our natural way. It is always ambiguous, or more accurately ‘undecidable’, whether the supplement adds itself and “is a plenitude enriching another plenitude, the fullest measure of presence”, or whether “the supplement supplements… adds only to replace… represents and makes an image… its place is assigned in the structure by the mark of an emptiness” (OG 144). Ultimately, Derrida suggests that the supplement is both of these things, accretion and substitution (OG 200), which means that the supplement is “not a signified more than a signifier, a representer than a presence, a writing than a speech” (OG 315). It comes before all such modalities.

This is not just some rhetorical suggestion that has no concrete significance in deconstruction. Indeed, while Rousseau consistently laments the frequency of his masturbation in his book, The Confessions, Derrida argues that “it has never been possible to desire the presence ‘in person’, before this play of substitution and the symbolic experience of auto-affection” (OG 154). By this, Derrida means that this supplementary masturbation that ‘plays’ between presence and absence (eg. the image of the absent Therese that is evoked by Rousseau) is that which allows us to conceive of being present and fulfilled in sexual relations with another at all. In a sense, masturbation is ‘originary’, and according to Derrida, this situation applies to all sexual relations. All erotic relations have their own supplementary aspect in which we are never present to some ephemeral ‘meaning’ of sexual relations, but always involved in some form of representation. Even if this does not literally take the form of imagining another in the place of, or supplementing the ‘presence’ that is currently with us, and even if we are not always acting out a certain role, or faking certain pleasures, for Derrida, such representations and images are the very conditions of desire and of enjoyment (OG 156).

4. Time and Phenomenology

Derrida has had a long and complicated association with phenomenology for his entire career, including ambiguous relationships with Husserl and Heidegger, and something closer to a sustained allegiance with Lévinas. Despite this complexity, two main aspects of Derrida’s thinking regarding phenomenology remain clear. Firstly, he thinks that the phenomenological emphasis upon the immediacy of experience is the new transcendental illusion, and secondly, he argues that despite its best intents, phenomenology cannot be anything other than a metaphysics (SP 75, 104). In this context, Derrida defines metaphysics as the science of presence, as for him (as for Heidegger), all metaphysics privileges presence, or that which is. While they are presented schematically here, these inter-related claims constitute Derrida’s major arguments against phenomenology.

According to Derrida, phenomenology is a metaphysics of presence because it unwittingly relies upon the notion of an indivisible self-presence, or in the case of Husserl, the possibility of an exact internal adequation with oneself (SP 66-8). In various texts, Derrida contests this valorisation of an undivided subjectivity, as well as the primacy that such a position accords to the ‘now’, or to some other kind of temporal immediacy. For instance, in Speech and Phenomena, Derrida argues that if a ‘now’ moment is conceived of as exhausting itself in that experience, it could not actually be experienced, for there would be nothing to juxtapose itself against in order to illuminate that very ‘now’. Instead, Derrida wants to reveal that every so-called ‘present’, or ‘now’ point, is always already compromised by a trace, or a residue of a previous experience, that precludes us ever being in a self-contained ‘now’ moment (SP 68). Phenomenology is hence envisaged as nostalgically seeking the impossible: that is, coinciding with oneself in an immediate and pre-reflective spontaneity. Following this refutation of Husserlian temporality, Derrida remarks that “in the last analysis, what is at stake is… the privilege of the actual present, the now” (SP 62-3). Instead of emphasising the presence of a subject to themselves (ie. the so-called living-present), Derrida strategically utilises a conception of time that emphasises deferral. John Caputo expresses Derrida’s point succinctly when he claims that Derrida’s criticisms of Husserlian temporality in Speech and Phenomena involve an attempt to convey that: “What is really going on in things, what is really happening, is always “to come”. Every time you try to stabilise the meaning of a thing, try to fix it in its missionary position, the thing itself, if there is anything at all to it, slips away” (cf. SP 104, Caputo DN 31). To put Derrida’s point simplistically, it might be suggested that the meaning of a particular object, or a particular word, is never stable, but always in the process of change (eg. the dissemination of meaning for which deconstruction has become notorious). Moreover, the significance of that past change can only be appreciated from the future and, of course, that ‘future’ is itself implicated in a similar process of transformation were it ever to be capable of becoming ‘present’. The future that Derrida is referring to is hence not just a future that will become present, but the future that makes all ‘presence’ possible and also impossible. For Derrida, there can be no presence-to-self, or self-contained identity, because the ‘nature’ of our temporal existence is for this type of experience to elude us. Our predominant mode of being is what he will eventually term the messianic (see Section 6), in that experience is about the wait, or more aptly, experience is only when it is deferred. Derrida’s work offers many important temporal contributions of this quasi-transcendental variety.

5. Undecidability

In its first and most famous instantiation, undecidability is one of Derrida’s most important attempts to trouble dualisms, or more accurately, to reveal how they are always already troubled. An undecidable, and there are many of them in deconstruction (eg. ghost, pharmakon, hymen, etc.), is something that cannot conform to either polarity of a dichotomy (eg. present/absent, cure/poison, and inside/outside in the above examples). For example, the figure of a ghost seems to neither present or absent, or alternatively it is both present and absent at the same time (SM).

However, Derrida has a recurring tendency to resuscitate terms in different contexts, and the term undecidability also returns in later deconstruction. Indeed, to complicate matters, undecidability returns in two discernible forms. In his recent work, Derrida often insists that the condition of the possibility of mourning, giving, forgiving, and hospitality, to cite some of his most famous examples, is at once also the condition of their impossibility (see section 7). In his explorations of these “possible-impossible” aporias, it becomes undecidable whether genuine giving, for example, is either a possible or an impossible ideal.

a. Decision

Derrida’s later philosophy is also united by his analysis of a similar type of undecidability that is involved in the concept of the decision itself. In this respect, Derrida regularly suggests that a decision cannot be wise, or posed even more provocatively, that the instant of the decision must actually be mad (DPJ 26, GD 65). Drawing on Kierkegaard, Derrida tells us that a decision requires an undecidable leap beyond all prior preparations for that decision (GD 77), and according to him, this applies to all decisions and not just those regarding the conversion to religious faith that preoccupies Kierkegaard. To pose the problem in inverse fashion, it might be suggested that for Derrida, all decisions are a faith and a tenuous faith at that, since were faith and the decision not tenuous, they would cease to be a faith or a decision at all (cf. GD 80). This description of the decision as a moment of madness that must move beyond rationality and calculative reasoning may seem paradoxical, but it might nevertheless be agreed that a decision requires a ‘leap of faith’ beyond the sum total of the facts. Many of us are undoubtedly stifled by the difficulty of decision-making, and this psychological fact aids and, for his detractors, also abets Derrida’s discussion of the decision as it appears in texts like The Gift of Death, Deconstruction and the Possibility of Justice, Adieu to Emmanuel Lévinas, and Politics of Friendship.

In Adieu to Emmanuel Lévinas, Derrida argues that a decision must always come back to the other, even if it is the other ‘inside’ the subject, and he disputes that an initiative which remained purely and simply “mine” would still be a decision (AEL 23-4). A theory of the subject is incapable of accounting for the slightest decision (PF 68-9), because, as he rhetorically asks, “would we not be justified in seeing here the unfolding of an egological immanence, the autonomic and automatic deployment of predicates or possibilities proper to a subject, without the tearing rupture that should occur in every decision we call free?” (AEL 24). In other words, if a decision is envisaged as simply following from certain character attributes, then it would not genuinely be a decision. Derrida is hence once more insisting upon the necessity of a leap beyond calculative reasoning, and beyond the resources of some self-contained subject reflecting upon the matter at hand. A decision must invoke that which is outside of the subject’s control. If a decision is an example of a concept that is simultaneously impossible within its own internal logic and yet nevertheless necessary, then not only is our reticence to decide rendered philosophically cogent, but it is perhaps even privileged. Indeed, Derrida’s work has been described as a “philosophy of hesitation”, and his most famous neologism, différance, explicitly emphasises deferring, with all of the procrastination that this term implies. Moreover, in his early essay “Violence and Metaphysics”, Derrida also suggests that a successful deconstructive reading is conditional upon the suspension of choice: on hesitating between the ethical opening and the logocentric totality (WD 84). Even though Derrida has suggested that he is reluctant to use the term ‘ethics’ because of logocentric associations, one is led to conclude that ‘ethical’ behaviour (for want of a better word) is a product of deferring, and of being forever open to possibilities rather than taking a definitive position. The problem of undecidability is also evident in more recent texts including The Gift of Death. In this text, Derrida seems to support the sacrificing of a certain notion of ethics and universality for a conception of radical singularity not unlike that evinced by the “hyper-ethical” sacrifice that Abraham makes of his son upon Mt Moriah, according to both the Judaic and Christian religions alike (GD 71). To represent Derrida’s position more precisely, true responsibility consists in oscillating between the demands of that which is wholly other (in Abraham’s case, God, but also any particular other) and the more general demands of a community (see Section 6). Responsibility is enduring this trial of the undecidable decision, where attending to the call of a particular other will inevitably demand an estrangement from the “other others” and their communal needs. Whatever decision one may take, according to Derrida, it can never be wholly justified (GD 70). Of course, Derrida’s emphasis upon the undecidability inherent in all decision-making does not want to convey inactivity or a quietism of despair, and he has insisted that the madness of the decision also demands urgency and precipitation (DPJ 25-8). Nevertheless, what is undergone is described as the “trial of undecidability” (LI 210) and what is involved in enduring this trial would seem to be a relatively anguished being. In an interview with Richard Beardsworth, Derrida characterises the problem of undecidability as follows: “However careful one is in the theoretical preparation of a decision, the instant of the decision, if there is to be a decision, must be heterogeneous to the accumulation of knowledge. Otherwise, there is no responsibility. In this sense not only must the person taking the decision not know everything… the decision, if there is to be one, must advance towards a future which is not known, which cannot be anticipated” (NM 37). This suggestion that the decision cannot anticipate the future is undoubtedly somewhat counter-intuitive, but Derrida’s rejection of anticipation is not only a rejection of the traditional idea of deciding on the basis of weighing-up and internally representing certain options. By suggesting that anticipation is not possible, he means to make the more general point that no matter how we may anticipate any decision must always rupture those anticipatory frameworks. A decision must be fundamentally different from any prior preparations for it. As Derrida suggests in Politics of Friendship, the decision must “surprise the very subjectivity of the subject” (PF 68), and it is in making this leap away from calculative reasoning that Derrida argues that responsibility consists (PF 69).

6. The Other

a. Responsibility to the Other

Perhaps the most obvious aspect of Derrida’s later philosophy is his advocation of the tout autre, the wholly other, and The Gift of Death will be our main focus in explaining what this exaltation of the wholly other might mean. Any attempt to sum up this short but difficult text would have to involve the recognition of a certain incommensurability between the particular and the universal, and the dual demands placed upon anybody intending to behave responsibly. For Derrida, the paradox of responsible behaviour means that there is always a question of being responsible before a singular other (eg. a loved one, God, etc.), and yet we are also always referred to our responsibility towards others generally and to what we share with them. Derrida insists that this type of aporia, or problem, is too often ignored by the “knights of responsibility” who presume that accountability and responsibility in all aspects of life – whether that be guilt before the human law, or even before the divine will of God – is quite easily established (GD 85). These are the same people who insist that concrete ethical guidelines should be provided by any philosopher worth his or her ‘salt’ (GD 67) and who ignore the difficulties involved in a notion like responsibility, which demands something importantly different from merely behaving dutifully (GD 63).

Derrida’s exploration of Abraham’s strange and paradoxical responsibility before the demands of God, which consists in sacrificing his only son Isaac, but also in betraying the ethical order through his silence about this act (GD 57-60), is designed to problematise this type of ethical concern that exclusively locates responsibility in the realm of generality. In places, Derrida even verges on suggesting that this more common notion of responsibility, which insists that one should behave according to a general principle that is capable of being rationally validated and justified in the public realm (GD 60), should be replaced with something closer to an Abrahamian individuality where the demands of a singular other (eg. God) are importantly distinct from the ethical demands of our society (GD 61, 66). Derrida equivocates regarding just how far he wants to endorse such a conception of responsibility, and also on the entire issue of whether Abraham’s willingness to murder is an act of faith, or simply an unforgivable transgression. As he says, “Abraham is at the same time, the most moral and the most immoral, the most responsible and the most irresponsible” (GD 72). This equivocation is, of course, a defining trait of deconstruction, which has been variously pilloried and praised for this refusal to propound anything that the tradition could deem to be a thesis. Nevertheless, it is relatively clear that in The Gift of Death, Derrida intends to free us from the common assumption that responsibility is to be associated with behaviour that accords with general principles capable of justification in the public realm (ie. liberalism). In opposition to such an account, he emphasises the “radical singularity” of the demands placed upon Abraham by God (GD 60, 68, 79) and those that might be placed on us by our own loved ones. Ethics, with its dependence upon generality, must be continually sacrificed as an inevitable aspect of the human condition and its aporetic demand to decide (GD 70). As Derrida points out, in writing about one particular cause rather than another, in pursuing one profession over another, in spending time with one’s family rather than at work, one inevitably ignores the “other others” (GD 69), and this is a condition of any and every existence. He argues that: “I cannot respond to the call, the request, the obligation, or even the love of another, without sacrificing the other other, the other others” (GD 68). For Derrida, it seems that the Buddhist desire to have attachment to nobody and equal compassion for everybody is an unattainable ideal. He does, in fact, suggest that a universal community that excludes no one is a contradiction in terms. According to him, this is because: “I am responsible to anyone (that is to say, to any other) only by failing in my responsibility to all the others, to the ethical or political generality. And I can never justify this sacrifice; I must always hold my peace about it… What binds me to this one or that one, remains finally unjustifiable” (GD 70). Derrida hence implies that responsibility to any particular individual is only possible by being irresponsible to the “other others”, that is, to the other people and possibilities that haunt any and every existence.

b. Wholly Other/Messianic

This brings us to a term that Derrida has resuscitated from its association with Walter Benjamin and the Judaic tradition more generally. That term is the messianic and it relies upon a distinction with messianism.

According to Derrida, the term messianism refers predominantly to the religions of the Messiahs – ie. the Muslim, Judaic and Christian religions. These religions proffer a Messiah of known characteristics, and often one who is expected to arrive at a particular time or place. The Messiah is inscribed in their respective religious texts and in an oral tradition that dictates that only if the other conforms to such and such a description is that person actually the Messiah. The most obvious of numerous necessary characteristics for the Messiah, it seems, is that they must invariably be male. Sexuality might seem to be a strange prerequisite to tether to that which is beyond this world, wholly other, but it is only one of many. Now, Derrida is not simplistically disparaging religion and the messianisms they propound. In an important respect, the messianic depends upon the various messianisms and Derrida admits that he cannot say which is the more originary. The messianism of Abraham in his singular responsibility before God, for Derrida, reveals the messianic structure of existence more generally, in that we all share a similar relationship to alterity even if we have not named and circumscribed that experience according to the template provided by a particular religion. However, Derrida’s call to the wholly other, his invocation for the wholly other “to come”, is not a call for a fixed or identifiable other of known characteristics, as is arguably the case in the average religious experience. His wholly other is indeterminable and can never actually arrive. Derrida more than once recounts a story of Maurice Blanchot’s where the Messiah was actually at the gates to a city, disguised in rags. After some time, the Messiah was finally recognised by a beggar, but the beggar could think of nothing more relevant to ask than: “when will you come?”(DN 24). Even when the Messiah is ‘there’, he or she must still be yet to come, and this brings us back to the distinction between the messianic and the various historical messianisms. The messianic structure of existence is open to the coming of an entirely ungraspable and unknown other, but the concrete, historical messianisms are open to the coming of a specific other of known characteristics. The messianic refers predominantly to a structure of our existence that involves waiting – waiting even in activity – and a ceaseless openness towards a future that can never be circumscribed by the horizons of significance that we inevitably bring to bear upon that possible future. In other words, Derrida is not referring to a future that will one day become present (or a particular conception of the saviour who will arrive), but to an openness towards an unknown futurity that is necessarily involved in what we take to be ‘presence’ and hence also renders it ‘impossible’. A deconstruction that entertained any type of grand prophetic narrative, like a Marxist story about the movement of history toward a pre-determined future which, once attained, would make notions like history and progress obsolete, would be yet another vestige of logocentrism and susceptible to deconstruction (SM). Precisely in order to avoid the problems that such messianisms engender – eg. killing in the name of progress, mutilating on account of knowing the will of God better than others, etc. – Derrida suggests that: “I am careful to say ‘let it come’ because if the other is precisely what is not invented, the initiative or deconstructive inventiveness can consist only in opening, in uncloseting, in destabilising foreclusionary structures, so as to allow for the passage toward the other” (RDR 60).

7. Possible and Impossible Aporias

Derrida has recently become more and more preoccupied with what has come to be termed “possible-impossible aporias” – aporia was originally a Greek term meaning puzzle, but it has come to mean something more like an impasse or paradox. In particular, Derrida has described the paradoxes that afflict notions like giving, hospitality, forgiving and mourning. He argues that the condition of their possibility is also, and at once, the condition of their impossibility. In this section, I will attempt to reveal the shared logic upon which these aporias rely.

a. The Gift

The aporia that surrounds the gift revolves around the paradoxical thought that a genuine gift cannot actually be understood to be a gift. In his text, Given Time, Derrida suggests that the notion of the gift contains an implicit demand that the genuine gift must reside outside of the oppositional demands of giving and taking, and beyond any mere self-interest or calculative reasoning (GT 30). According to him, however, a gift is also something that cannot appear as such (GD 29), as it is destroyed by anything that proposes equivalence or recompense, as well as by anything that even proposes to know of, or acknowledge it. This may sound counter-intuitive, but even a simple ‘thank-you’ for instance, which both acknowledges the presence of a gift and also proposes some form of equivalence with that gift, can be seen to annul the gift (cf. MDM 149). By politely responding with a ‘thank-you’, there is often, and perhaps even always, a presumption that because of this acknowledgement one is no longer indebted to the other who has given, and that nothing more can be expected of an individual who has so responded. Significantly, the gift is hence drawn into the cycle of giving and taking, where a good deed must be accompanied by a suitably just response. As the gift is associated with a command to respond, it becomes an imposition for the receiver, and it even becomes an opportunity to take for the ‘giver’, who might give just to receive the acknowledgement from the other that they have in fact given. There are undoubtedly many other examples of how the ‘gift’ can be deployed, and not necessarily deliberately, to gain advantage. Of course, it might be objected that even if it is psychologically difficult to give without also receiving (and in a manner that is tantamount to taking) this does not in-itself constitute a refutation of the logic of genuine giving. According to Derrida, however, his discussion does not amount merely to an empirical or psychological claim about the difficulty of transcending an immature and egocentric conception of giving. On the contrary, he wants to problematise the very possibility of a giving that can be unequivocally disassociated from receiving and taking.

The important point is that, for Derrida, a genuine gift requires an anonymity of the giver, such that there is no accrued benefit in giving. The giver cannot even recognise that they are giving, for that would be to reabsorb their gift to the other person as some kind of testimony to the worth of the self – ie. the kind of self-congratulatory logic that rhetorically poses the question “how wonderful I am to give this person that which they have always desired, and without even letting them know that I am responsible?”. This is an extreme example, but Derrida claims that such a predicament afflicts all giving in more or less obvious ways. For him, the logic of a genuine gift actually requires that self and other be radically disparate, and have no obligations or claims upon each other of any kind. He argues that a genuine gift must involve neither an apprehension of a good deed done, nor the recognition by the other party that they have received, and this seems to render the actuality of any gift an impossibility. Significantly, however, according to Derrida, the existential force of this demand for an absolute altruism can never be assuaged, and yet equally clearly it can also never be fulfilled, and this ensures that the condition of the possibility of the gift is inextricably associated with its impossibility. For Derrida, there is no solution to this type of problem, and no hint of a dialectic that might unify the apparent incommensurability in which possibility implies impossibility and vice versa. At the same time, however, he does not intend simply to vacillate in hyperbolic and self-referential paradoxes. There is a sense in which deconstruction actually seeks genuine giving, hospitality, forgiving and mourning, even where it acknowledges that these concepts are forever elusive and can never actually be fulfilled.

b. Hospitality

It is also worth considering the aporia that Derrida associates with hospitality. According to Derrida, genuine hospitality before any number of unknown others is not, strictly speaking, a possible scenario (OH 135, GD 70, AEL 50, OCF 16). If we contemplate giving up everything that we seek to possess and call our own, then most of us can empathise with just how difficult enacting any absolute hospitality would be. Despite this, however, Derrida insists that the whole idea of hospitality depends upon such an altruistic concept and is inconceivable without it (OCF 22). In fact, he argues that it is this internal tension that keeps the concept alive.

As Derrida makes explicit, there is a more existential example of this tension, in that the notion of hospitality requires one to be the ‘master’ of the house, country or nation (and hence controlling). His point is relatively simple here; to be hospitable, it is first necessary that one must have the power to host. Hospitality hence makes claims to property ownership and it also partakes in the desire to establish a form of self-identity. Secondly, there is the further point that in order to be hospitable, the host must also have some kind of control over the people who are being hosted. This is because if the guests take over a house through force, then the host is no longer being hospitable towards them precisely because they are no longer in control of the situation. This means, for Derrida, that any attempt to behave hospitably is also always partly betrothed to the keeping of guests under control, to the closing of boundaries, to nationalism, and even to the exclusion of particular groups or ethnicities (OH 151-5). This is Derrida’s ‘possible’ conception of hospitality, in which our most well-intentioned conceptions of hospitality render the “other others” as strangers and refugees (cf. OH 135, GD 68). Whether one invokes the current international preoccupation with border control, or simply the ubiquitous suburban fence and alarm system, it seems that hospitality always posits some kind of limit upon where the other can trespass, and hence has a tendency to be rather inhospitable. On the other hand, as well as demanding some kind of mastery of house, country or nation, there is a sense in which the notion of hospitality demands a welcoming of whomever, or whatever, may be in need of that hospitality. It follows from this that unconditional hospitality, or we might say ‘impossible’ hospitality, hence involves a relinquishing of judgement and control in regard to who will receive that hospitality. In other words, hospitality also requires non-mastery, and the abandoning of all claims to property, or ownership. If that is the case, however, the ongoing possibility of hospitality thereby becomes circumvented, as there is no longer the possibility of hosting anyone, as again, there is no ownership or control.

c. Forgiveness

Derrida discerns another aporia in regard to whether or not to forgive somebody who has caused us significant suffering or pain. This particular paradox revolves around the premise that if one forgives something that is actually forgivable, then one simply engages in calculative reasoning and hence does not really forgive. Most commonly in interviews, but also in his recent text On Cosmopolitanism and Forgiveness, Derrida argues that according to its own internal logic, genuine forgiving must involve the impossible: that is, the forgiving of an ‘unforgivable’ transgression – eg. a ‘mortal sin’ (OCF 32, cf. OH 39). There is hence a sense in which forgiving must be ‘mad’ and ‘unconscious’ (OCF 39, 49), and it must also remain outside of, or heterogenous to, political and juridical rationality. This unconditional ‘forgiveness’ explicitly precludes the necessity of an apology or repentance by the guilty party, although Derrida acknowledges that this pure notion of forgiveness must always exist in tension with a more conditional forgiveness where apologies are actually demanded. However, he argues that this conditional forgiveness amounts more to amnesty and reconciliation than to genuine forgiveness (OCF 51). The pattern of this discussion is undoubtedly beginning to become familiar. Derrida’s discussions of forgiving are orientated around revealing a fundamental paradox that ensures that forgiving can never be finished or concluded – it must always be open, like a permanent rupture, or a wound that refuses to heal.

This forgiveness paradox depends, in one of its dual aspects, upon a radical disjunction between self and other. Derrida explicitly states that “genuine forgiveness must engage two singularities: the guilty and the victim. As soon as a third party intervenes, one can again speak of amnesty, reconciliation, reparation, etc., but certainly not of forgiveness in the strict sense” (OCF 42). Given that he also acknowledges that it is difficult to conceive of any such face-to-face encounter without a third party – as language itself must serve such a mediating function (OCF 48) – forgiveness is caught in an aporia that ensures that its empirical actuality looks to be decidedly unlikely. To recapitulate, the reason that Derrida’s notion of forgiveness is caught in such an inextricable paradox is because absolute forgiveness requires a radically singular confrontation between self and other, while conditional forgiveness requires the breaching of categories such as self and other, either by a mediating party, or simply by the recognition of the ways in which we are always already intertwined with the other. Indeed, Derrida explicitly argues that when we know anything of the other, or even understand their motivation in however minimal a way, this absolute forgiveness can no longer take place (OCF 49). Derrida can offer no resolution in regard to the impasse that obtains between these two notions (between possible and impossible forgiving, between an amnesty where apologies are asked for and a more absolute forgiveness). He will only insist that an oscillation between both sides of the aporia is necessary for responsibility (OCF 51).

d. Mourning

In Memoires: for Paul de Man, which was written almost immediately following de Man’s death in 1983, Derrida reflects upon the political significance of his colleague’s apparent Nazi affiliation in his youth, and he also discusses the pain of losing his friend. Derrida’s argument about mourning adheres to a similarly paradoxical logic to that which has been associated with him throughout this article. He suggests that the so-called ‘successful’ mourning of the deceased other actually fails – or at least is an unfaithful fidelity – because the other person becomes a part of us, and in this interiorisation their genuine alterity is no longer respected. On the other hand, failure to mourn the other’s death paradoxically appears to succeed, because the presence of the other person in their exteriority is prolonged (MDM 6). As Derrida suggests, there is a sense in which “an aborted interiorisation is at the same time a respect for the other as other” (MDM 35). Hence the possibility of an impossible bereavement, where the only possible way to mourn, is to be unable to do so. However, even though this is how he initially presents the problem, Derrida also problematises this “success fails, failure succeeds” formulation (MDM 35).

In his essay “Fors: The Anglish Words of Nicolas Abraham and Maria Torok”, Derrida again considers two models of the type of encroachment between self and other that is regularly associated with mourning. Borrowing from post-Freudian theories of mourning, he posits (although later undermines) a difference between introjection, which is love for the other in me, and incorporation, which involves retaining the other as a pocket, or a foreign body within one’s own body. For Freud, as well as for the psychologists Abraham and Torok whose work Derrida considers, successful mourning is primarily about the introjection of the other. The preservation of a discrete and separate other person inside the self (psychologically speaking), as is the case in incorporation, is considered to be where mourning ceases to be a ‘normal’ response and instead becomes pathological. Typically, Derrida reverses this hierarchy by highlighting that there is a sense in which the supposedly pathological condition of incorporation is actually more respectful of the other person’s alterity. After all, incorporation means that one has not totally assimilated the other, as there is still a difference and a heterogeneity (EO 57). On the other hand, Abraham and Torok’s so-called ‘normal’ mourning can be accused of interiorising the other person to such a degree that they have become assimilated and even metaphorically cannibalised. Derrida considers this introjection to be an infidelity to the other. However, Derrida’s account is not so simple as to unreservedly valorise the incorporation of the other person, even if he emphasises this paradigm in an effort to refute the canonical interpretation of successful mourning. He also acknowledges that the more the self “keeps the foreign element inside itself, the more it excludes it” (Fors xvii). If we refuse to engage with the dead other, we also exclude their foreignness from ourselves and hence prevent any transformative interaction with them. When fetishised in their externality in such a manner, the dead other really is lifeless and it is significant that Derrida describes the death of de Man in terms of the loss of exchange and of the transformational opportunities that he presented (MDM xvi, cf WM). Derrida’s point hence seems to be that in mourning, the ‘otherness of the other’ person resists both the process of incorporation as well as the process of introjection. The other can neither be preserved as a foreign entity, nor introjected fully within. Towards the end of Memoires: for Paul de Man, Derrida suggests that responsibility towards the other is about respecting and even emphasising this resistance (MDM 160, 238).

8. References and Further Reading

a. Derrida’s Texts (and Their Abbreviations)

• Acts of Literature, ed. Attridge, New York: Routledge, 1992 (AL).
• Adieu to Emmanuel Lévinas, trans. Brault & Naas, Stanford, California: Stanford University Press, 1999 (AEL).
• Circumfessions: Fifty Nine Periphrases, in Bennington, G., Jacques Derrida, Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1993 (Circ).
• On Cosmopolitanism and Forgiveness, London: Routledge, 2001 (OCF).
• Deconstruction and the Possibility of Justice, (inc. “Force of the Law”), eds. Cornell, Carlson, & Benjamin, New York: Routledge, 1992 (DPJ).
• Dissemination, trans. Johnson, Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1981 (D).
• “‘Eating Well’ or the Calculation of the Subject: An Interview with Jacques Derrida” in Who Comes After the Subject? eds. Cadava, Connor, & Nancy, New York: Routledge, 1991, p 96-119.
• The Ear of the Other: Otobiography, Transference, Translation, trans. Kamuf, ed. McDonald, New York: Schocken Books, 1985 (EO).
• Edmund Husserl’s ‘Origin of Geometry’: An Introduction, trans. Leavey, Pittsburgh: Duquesne University Press, 1978 (1962) (HOG).
• “Fors: The Anglish Words of Nicolas Abraham and Maria Torok”, trans. Johnson, in The Wolfman’s Magic Word: A Cryptonomy, Abraham, N., & Torok, M., trans. Rand, Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press, 1986 (Fors).
• The Gift of Death, trans. Wills, Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1995 (1991) (GD).
• Given Time: i. Counterfeit Money, trans. Kamuf, Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1992 (GT).
• “Hostipitality” in Angelaki: Journal of the Theoretical Humanities, Vol. 5, Number 3, Dec 2000.
• Le Toucher: Jean-Luc Nancy, Paris: Galilée, 2000 (T).
• “Le Toucher: Touch/to touch him”, in Paragraph, trans. Kamuf, 16:2, 1993, p 122-57.
• Limited Inc. (inc. “Afterword”), ed. Graff, trans. Weber, Evanston: Northwestern University Press, 1998 edition (LI).
• Margins of Philosophy, trans. Bass, Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1982 (M).
• Memoires: for Paul de Man, trans. Lindsay, Culler, Cadava, & Kamuf, New York: Columbia University Press, 1989 (MDM).
• Memoirs of the Blind: The Self-Portrait and Other Ruins, trans. Brault & Naas, Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1993 (1991) (MB).
• Monolingualism of the Other or the Prosthesis of Origin, trans. Mensh, Stanford: Stanford University Press, 1996 (MO).
• “Nietzsche and the Machine: Interview with Jacques Derrida” (interviewer Beardsworth) in Journal of Nietzsche Studies, Issue 7, Spring 1994 (NM). Of Grammatology, trans. Spivak, Baltimore: John Hopkins University Press, 1976 (OG).
• Derrida, J., & Dufourmantelle, A., Of Hospitality, trans. Bowlby, Stanford: Stanford University Press, 2000 (OH).
• On the Name (inc. “Passions”), ed. Dutoit, Stanford: Stanford University Press, 1995 (ON).
• “Ousia and Gramme: A Note to a Footnote in Being and Time” trans. Casey in Phenomenology in Perspective, ed. Smith, The Hague: Nijhoff, 1970.
• Parages, Paris: Galilée, 1986. Points… Interviews, 1974-1995, ed. Weber, trans. Kamuf et al, Stanford: Stanford University Press, 1995 (P).
• Politics of Friendship, trans. Collins, New York: Verso, 1997 (PF).
• Positions, trans. Bass, London: Athlone Press, 1981 (1972) (PO).
• “Psyche: Inventions of the Other” in Reading De Man Reading, eds. Waters & Godzich, Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press, 1989 (RDR).
• Spectres of Marx: The State of the Debt, the Work of Mourning and the New International, trans. Kamuf, New York: Routledge, 1994 (SM).
• ‘Speech and Phenomena’ and Other Essays on Husserl’s Theory of Signs, trans. Allison, Evanston: Northwestern University Press, 1973 (1967) (SP).
• The Work of Mourning, eds. Brault & Naas, Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 2001 (WM).
• Writing and Difference, trans. Bass, Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1978 (1967) (WD).

b. Selected Commentaries

• Bennington, G., Interrupting Derrida, Warwick Studies in European Philosophy, London: Routledge, 2000.
• Bennington, G., Jacques Derrida, Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1993.
• Caputo, J., Deconstruction in a Nutshell, New York: Fordham University Press, 1997.
• Caputo, J., The Prayers and Tears of Jacques Derrida, Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1997.
• Critchley, S., The Ethics of Deconstruction: Derrida and Lévinas, Oxford, UK: Blackwell, 1992.
• Culler, J., On Deconstruction: Theory and Criticism after Structuralism, London: Routledge and Kegan Paul, 1983.
• Gasché, R., Inventions of Difference: On Jacques Derrida, Massachusetts: Harvard University Press, 1994. Gasché, R., The Tain of the Mirror: Derrida and the Philosophy of Reflection, Massachusetts: Harvard University Press, 1986.
• Hart, K., The Trespass of the Sign: Deconstruction, Theology and Philosophy, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1989.
• Harvey, I., Derrida and the Economy of Différance, Studies in Phenomenology and Existential Philosophy, Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1986.
• Howells, C., Derrida: Deconstruction from Phenomenology to Ethics, Cambridge: Polity Press, 1999.
• Krell, D., The Purest of Bastards: Works of Art, Affirmation and Mourning in the Thought of Jacques Derrida, Pennsylvania: Pennsylvania University Press, 2000.
• Norris, C., Derrida, Massachusetts: Harvard University Press, 1987.
• Patrick, M., Derrida, Responsibility and Politics, Avebury Series in Philosophy, Aldershot: Ashgate Publishing, 1997.
• Silverman, H., ed. Derrida and Deconstruction, New York: Routledge, 1989.
• Wood, D., The Deconstruction of Time, Contemporary Studies in Philosophy and the Human Sciences, Atlantic Highlands, New Jersey: Humanities Press, 1989.
• Wood, D., ed. Derrida: A Critical Reader, Oxford: Blackwell, 1992.
• Wood, D., & Bernasconi, R., eds. Derrida and Différance, Evanston: Northwestern University Press, 1988.

Author Information

Jack Reynolds
Email: Jack.Reynolds@latrobe.edu.au
La Trobe University
Australia

Martin Heidegger (1889—1976)

Martin Heidegger is widely acknowledged to be one of the most original and important philosophers of the 20^th century, while remaining one of the most controversial.  His thinking has contributed to such diverse fields as phenomenology (Merleau-Ponty), existentialism (Sartre, Ortega y Gasset), hermeneutics (Gadamer, Ricoeur), political theory (Arendt, Marcuse, Habermas), psychology (Boss, Binswanger, Rollo May), and theology (Bultmann, Rahner, Tillich). His critique of traditional metaphysics and his opposition to positivism and technological world domination have been embraced by leading theorists of postmodernity (Derrida, Foucault, and Lyotard). On the other hand, his involvement in the Nazi movement has invoked a stormy debate.  Although he never claimed that his philosophy was concerned with politics, political considerations have come to overshadow his philosophical work.

Heidegger’s main interest was ontology or the study of being. In his fundamental treatise, Being and Time, he attempted to access being (Sein) by means of phenomenological analysis of human existence (Dasein) in respect to its temporal and historical character. After the change of his thinking (“the turn”), Heidegger placed an emphasis on language as the vehicle through which the question of being can be unfolded. He turned to the exegesis of historical texts, especially of the Presocratics, but also of Kant, Hegel, Nietzsche and Hölderlin, and to poetry, architecture, technology, and other subjects. Instead of looking for a full clarification of the meaning of being, he tried to pursue a kind of thinking which was no longer “metaphysical.” He criticized the tradition of Western philosophy, which he regarded as nihilistic, for, as he claimed, the question of being as such was obliterated in it. He also stressed the nihilism of modern technological culture. By going to the Presocratic beginning of Western thought, he wanted to repeat the early Greek experience of being, so that the West could turn away from the dead end of nihilism and begin anew. His writings are notoriously difficult. Being and Time remains his most influential work.

Table of Contents

1. Life and Works
2. Philosophy as Phenomenological Ontology
3. Dasein and Temporality
4. The Quest for the Meaning of Being
5. Overcoming Metaphysics
6. From the First Beginning to the New Beginning
7. From Philosophy to Political Theory
8. Heidegger’s Collected Works
   1. Published Writings, 1910-1976
   2. Lectures from Marburg and Freiburg, 1919-1944
   3. Private Monographs and Lectures, 1919-1967
   4. Notes and Fragments

1. Life and Works

Heidegger was born on September 26, 1889 in Messkirch in south-west Germany to a Catholic family. His father worked as sexton in the local church. In his early youth, Heidegger was being prepared for the priesthood. In 1903 he went to the high school in Konstanz, where the church supported him with a scholarship, and then, in 1906, he moved to Freiburg. His interest in philosophy first arose during his high school studies in Freiburg when, at the age of seventeen, he read Franz Brentano’s book entitled On the Manifold Meaning of Being according to Aristotle. By his own account, it was this work that inspired his life-long quest for the meaning of being. In 1909, after completing the high school, he became a Jesuit novice, but was discharged within a month for reasons of health. He then entered Freiburg University, where he studied theology. However, because of health problems and perhaps because of a lack of a strong spiritual vocation, Heidegger left the seminary in 1911 and broke off his training for the priesthood. He took up studies in philosophy, mathematics, and natural sciences. It was also at that time that he first became influenced by Edmund Husserl. He studied Husserl’s Logical Investigations. In 1913 he completed a doctorate in philosophy with a dissertation on The Doctrine of Judgement in Psychologism under the direction of the neo-Kantian philosopher Heinrich Rickert.

The outbreak of the First World War interrupted Heidegger’s academic career only briefly. He was conscripted into the army, but was discharged after two months because of health reasons. Hoping to take over the chair of Catholic philosophy at Freiburg, Heidegger now began to work on a habilitation thesis, the required qualification for teaching at the university. His thesis, Duns Scotus’s Doctrine of Categories and Meaning, was completed in 1915, and in the same year he was appointed a Privatdozent, or lecturer. He taught mostly courses in Aristotelian and scholastic philosophy, and regarded himself as standing in the service of the Catholic world-view. Nevertheless, his turn from theology to philosophy was soon to be followed by another turn.

In 1916, Heidegger became a junior colleague of Edmund Husserl when the latter joined the Freiburg faculty. The following year, he married Thea Elfride Petri, a Protestant student who had attended his courses since the fall of 1915. His career was again interrupted by military service in 1918. He served for the last ten months of the war, the last three of those in a meteorological unit on the western front. Within a few weeks of his return to Freiburg, he announced his break with the “system of Catholicism” (January 9, 1919), got appointed as Husserl’s assistant (January 21, 1919), and began lecturing in a new, insightful way (February 7, 1919). His lectures on phenomenology and his creative interpretations of Aristotle would now earn him a wide acclaim. And yet, Heidegger did not simply become Husserl’s faithful follower. In particular, he was not captivated by the later developments of Husserl’s thought—by his neo-Kantian turn towards transcendental subjectivity and even less by his Cartesianism—but continued to value his earlier work, Logical Investigations. Laboring over the question of things themselves, Heidegger soon began a radical reinterpretation of Husserl’s phenomenology.

In 1923, with the support of Paul Natorp, Heidegger was appointed associate professor at Marburg University. Between 1923 and 1928, he enjoyed there the most fruitful years of his entire teaching career. His students testified to the originality of his insight and the intensity of his philosophical questioning. Heidegger extended the scope of his lectures, and taught courses on the history of philosophy, time, logic, phenomenology, Plato, Aristotle, Aquinas, Kant, and Leibniz. However, he had published nothing since 1916, a factor that threatened his future academic career. Finally, in February 1927, partly because of administrative pressure, his fundamental but also unfinished treatise, Being and Time, appeared. Within a few years, this book was recognized as a truly epoch-making work of 20^th century philosophy. It earned Heidegger, in the fall of 1927, full professorship at Marburg, and one year later, after Husserl’s retirement from teaching, the chair of philosophy at Freiburg University. Although Being and Time is dedicated to Husserl, upon its publication Heidegger’s departure from Husserl’s phenomenology and the differences between two philosophers became apparent. In 1929, his next published works—“What is Metaphysics?,” “On the Essence of Ground,” and Kant and the Problem of Metaphysics—further revealed how far Heidegger had moved from neo-Kantianism and phenomenology of consciousness to his own phenomenological ontology.

Heidegger’s life entered a problematic and controversial stage with Hitler’s rise to power. In September 1930, Adolf Hitler’s National Socialist German Workers’ Party (NSDAP) became the second largest party in Germany, and on January 30, 1933 Hitler was appointed chancellor of Germany. Up to then virtually apolitical, Heidegger now became politically involved. On April 21, 1933, he was elected rector of the University of Freiburg by the faculty. He was apparently urged by his colleagues to become a candidate for this politically sensitive post, as he later claimed in an interview with Der Spiegel, to avoid the danger of a party functionary being appointed. But he also seemed to believe that he could steer the Nazi movement in the right direction. On May 3, 1933, he joined the NSDAP, or Nazi, party. On May 27, 1933, he delivered his inaugural rectoral address on “The Self-Assertion of the German University.” The ambiguous text of this speech has often been interpreted as an expression of his support for Hitler’s regime. During his tenure as rector he produced a number of speeches in the Nazi cause, such as, for example, “Declaration of Support for Adolf Hitler and the National Socialist State” delivered in November 1933. There is little doubt that during that time, Heidegger placed the great prestige of his scholarly reputation at the service of National Socialism, and thus, willingly or not, contributed to its legitimization among his fellow Germans. And yet, just one year later, on April 23, 1934, Heidegger resigned from his office and took no further part in politics. His rectoral address was found incompatible with the party line, and its text was eventually banned by the Nazis. Because he was no longer involved in the party’s activities, Heidegger’s membership in the NSDAP became a mere formality. Certain restrictions were put on his freedom to publish and attend conferences. In his lecture courses of the late 1930s and early 1940s, and especially in the course entitled Hölderlin’s Hymnen “Germanien” und “Der Rein” (Hölderlin’s Hymns “Germania” and “The Rhine”) originally presented at the University of Freiburg during the winter semester of 1934/35, he expressed covert criticism of Nazi ideology. He came under attack of Ernst Krieck, semi-official Nazi philosopher. For some time he was under the surveillance of the Gestapo. His final humiliation came in 1944, when he was declared the most “expendable” member of the faculty and sent to the Rhine to dig trenches. Following Germany’s defeat in the Second World War, Heidegger was accused of Nazi sympathies. He was forbidden to teach and in 1946 was dismissed from his chair of philosophy. The ban was lifted in 1949.

The 1930s are not only marked by Heidegger’s controversial involvement in politics, but also by a change in his thinking which is known as “the turn” (die Kehre). In his lectures and writings that followed “the turn,” he became less systematic and often more obscure than in his fundamental work, Being and Time. He turned to the exegesis of philosophical and literary texts, especially of the Presocratics, but also of Kant, Hegel, Nietzsche and Hölderlin, and makes this his way of philosophizing. A recurring theme of that time was “the essence of truth.” During the decade between 1931 and 1940, Heidegger offered five courses under this title. His preoccupation with the question of language and his fascination with poetry were expressed in lectures on Hörderlin which he gave between 1934 and 1936. Towards the end of 1930s and the beginning of 1940s, he taught five courses on Nietzsche, in which he submitted to criticism the tradition of western metaphysics, described by him as nihilistic, and made allusions to the absurdity of war and the bestiality of his contemporaries. Finally, his reflection upon the western philosophical tradition and an endeavor to open a space for philosophizing outside it, brought him to an examination of Presocratic thought. In the course of lectures entitled An Introduction to Metaphysics, which was originally offered as a course of lectures in 1935, and can be seen as a bridge between earlier and later Heidegger, the Presocratics were no longer a subject of mere passing remarks as in Heidegger’s earlier works. The course was not about early Greek thought, yet the Presocratics became there the pivotal center of discussion. It is clear that with the evolution of Heidegger’s thinking in the 1930s, they gained in importance in his work. During the 1940s, in addition to giving courses on Aristotle, Kant and Hegel, Heidegger lectured extensively on Anaximander, Parmenides, and Heraclitus.

During the last three decades of his life, from the mid 1940s to the mid 1970s, Heidegger wrote and published much, but in comparison to earlier decades, there was no significant change in his philosophy. In his insightful essays and lectures, such as “What are Poets for?” (1946), “Letter on Humanism” (1947), “The Question Concerning Technology” (1953), “The Way to Language” (1959), “Time and Being” (1962), and “The End of Philosophy and the Task of Thinking” (1964), he addressed different issues concerning modernity, labored on his original philosophy of history—the history of being—and attempted to clarify his way of thinking after “the turn”. Most of his time was divided between his home in Freiburg, his second study in Messkirch, and his mountain hut in the Black Forest. But he escaped provincialism by being frequently visited by his friends (including, among the others, the political philosopher Hannah Arendt, the physicist Werner Heisenberg, the theologian Rudolf Bultmann, the psychologist Ludwig Binswanger) and by traveling more widely than ever before. He lectured on “What is Philosophy?” at Cerisy-la-Salle in 1955, and on “Hegel and the Greeks” at Aix-en-Provence in 1957, and also visited Greece in 1962 and 1967. In 1966, Heidegger attempted to justify his political involvement during the Nazi regime in an interview with Der Spiegel entitled “Only God Can Save Us”. One of his last teaching stints was a seminar on Parmenides that he gave in Zähringen in 1973. Heiddegger died on May 26, 1976, and was buried in the churchyard in Messkirch. He remained intellectually active up until the very end, working on a number of projects, including the massive Gesamtausgabe, the complete edition of his works.

2. Philosophy as Phenomenological Ontology

In order to understand Heidegger’s philosophy before “the turn”, let us first briefly consider his indebtedness to Edmund Husserl. As it has been mentioned, Heidegger was interested in Husserl from his early student years at the University of Freiburg when he read Logical Investigations. Later, when Husserl accepted a chair at Freiburg, Heidegger became his assistant. His debt to Husserl cannot be overlooked. Not only is Being and Time dedicated to Husserl, but also Heidegger acknowledges in it that without Husserl’s phenomenology his own investigation would not have been possible. How then is Heidegger’s philosophy related to the Husserlian program of phenomenology?

By “phenomenology” Husserl himself had always meant the science of consciousness and its objects; this core of sense pervades the development of this concept as eidetic, transcendental or constructive throughout his works. Following the Cartesian tradition, he saw the ground and the absolute starting point of philosophy in the subject. The procedure of bracketing is essential to Husserl’s “phenomenological reduction”—the methodological procedure by which we are led from “the natural attitude,” in which we are involved in the actual world and its affairs, to “the phenomenological attitude,” in which the analysis and detached description of the content of consciousness is possible. The phenomenological reduction helps us to free ourselves from prejudices and secure the purity of our detachment as observers, so that we can encounter “things as they are in themselves” independently of any presuppositions. The goal of phenomenology for Husserl is then a descriptive, detached analysis of consciousness, in which objects, as its correlates, are constituted.

What right does Husserl have to insist that the original mode of encounter with beings, in which they appear to us as they are as things in themselves, is the encounter of consciousness purified by phenomenological reduction and its objects? “Whence and how is it determined what must be experienced as the ‘things themselves’ in accordance with the principle of phenomenology?” These are pressing questions which Heidegger might well have asked. Perhaps because of his reverence for Husserl, he does not subject him to direct criticism in his fundamental work. Nevertheless, Being and Time is itself a powerful critique of the Husserlian phenomenology. Heidegger there gives attention to many different modes in which we exist and encounter things. He analyses the structures constitutive of things not only as they are encountered in the detached, theoretical attitude of consciousness, but also in daily life as “utensils” (Zuhandene) or in special moods, especially in anxiety (Angst). What is more, he exhibits there the structures that are constitutive of the particular kind of being which is the human being and which he calls “Dasein.” For Heidegger, it is not pure consciousness in which beings are originally constituted. The starting point of philosophy for him is not consciousness, but Dasein in its being.

The central problem for Husserl is the problem of constitution: How is the world as phenomenon constituted in our consciousness? Heidegger takes the Husserlian problem one step further. Instead of asking how something must be given in consciousness in order to be constituted, he asks: “What is the mode of being of that being in which the world constitutes itself?” In a letter to Husserl dated October 27, 1927, he states that the question of Dasein’s being cannot be evaded, as far as the problem of constitution is concerned. Dasein is that being in which any being is constituted. Further, the question of Dasein’s being directs him to the problem of being in general. The “universal problem of being,” he says in the same letter, “refers to that which constitutes and to that which is constituted.” While far from being dependent upon Husserl, Heidegger finds in his thought an inspiration leading him to the theme which has continued to draw his attention since his early years: the question of the meaning of being.

Phenomenology thus receives in Heidegger a new meaning. He conceives it more broadly, and more etymologically, than Husserl, as “letting what shows itself to be seen from itself, just as it shows from itself.” Husserl applies the term “phenomenology” to a whole philosophy. Heidegger takes it rather to designate a method. Since in Being and Time philosophy is described as “ontology” and has being as its theme, it cannot adopt its method from any of the actual sciences. For Heidegger the method of ontology is phenomenology. “Phenomenology,” he says, “is the way of access to what is to become the theme of ontology.” Being is to be grasped by means of the phenomenological method. However, being is always the being of a being, and accordingly, it becomes accessible only indirectly through some existing entity. Therefore, “phenomenological reduction” is necessary. One must direct oneself toward an entity, but in such a way that its being is thereby brought out. It is Dasein which Heidegger chooses as the particular entity to access being. Hence, as the basic component of his phenomenology, Heidegger adopts the Husserlian phenomenological reduction, but gives it a completely different meaning.

To sum up, Heidegger does not base his philosophy on consciousness as Husserl did. For him the phenomenological or theoretical attitude of consciousness, which Husserl makes the core of his doctrine, is only one possible mode of that which is more fundamental, namely, Dasein’s being. Although he agrees with Husserl that the transcendental constitution of the world cannot be unveiled by naturalistic or physical explanations, in his view it is not a descriptive analysis of consciousness that leads to this end, but the analysis of Dasein. Phenomenology for him is not a descriptive, detached analysis of consciousness. It is a method of access to being. For the Heidegger of Being and Time, philosophy is phenomenological ontology which takes its departure from the analysis of Dasein.

3. Dasein and Temporality

In everyday German language the word “Dasein” means life or existence. The noun is used by other German philosophers to denote the existence of any entity. However, Heidegger breaks the word down to its components “Da” and “Sein,” and gives to it a special meaning which is related to his answer to the question of who the human being is. He relates this question to the question of being. Dasein, that being which we ourselves are, is distinguished from all other beings by the fact that it makes issue of its own being. It stands out to being. As Da-sein, it is the site, “Da”, for the disclosure of being, “Sein.”

Heidegger’s fundamental analysis of Dasein from Being and Time points to temporality as the primordial meaning of Dasein’s being. Dasein is essentially temporal. Its temporal character is derived from the tripartite ontological structure: existence, thrownness, and fallenness by which Dasein’s being is described. Existence means that Dasein is potentiality-for-being (Seinkönnen); it projects its being upon various possibilities. Existence represents thus the phenomenon of the future. Then, as thrownness, Dasein always finds itself already in a certain spiritual and material, historically conditioned environment; in short, in the world, in which the space of possibilities is always somehow limited. This represents the phenomenon of the past as having-been. Finally, as fallenness, Dasein exists in the midst of beings which are both Dasein and not Dasein. The encounter with those beings, “being-alongside” or “being-with” them, is made possible for Dasein by the presence of those beings within-the-world. This represents the primordial phenomenon of the present. Accordingly, Dasein is not temporal for the mere reason that it exists “in time,” but because its very being is rooted in temporality: the original unity of the future, the past and the present. Temporality cannot be identified with ordinary clock time – with simply being at one point in time, at one “Now” after another—which for Heidegger is a derivative phenomenon. Neither does Dasein’s temporality have the merely quantitative, homogeneous character of the concept of time found in natural science. It is the phenomenon of original time, of the time which “temporalizes” itself in the course of Dasein’s existence. It is a movement through a world as a space of possibilities. The “going back” to the possibilities that have been (the past) in the moment of thrownness, and their projection in the resolute movement “coming towards” (the future) in the moment of existence, which both take place in “being with” others (the present) in the moment of fallenness, provide for the original unity of the future, the past, and the present which constitutes authentic temporality.

As authentically temporal, Dasein as potentiality-for-being comes towards itself in its possibilities of being by going back to what has been; it always comes towards itself from out of a possibility of itself. Hence, it comports itself towards the future by always coming back to its past; the past which is not merely past but still around as having-been. But in this “going back” to what it has been which is constitutive together with “coming towards” and “being with” for the unity of Dasein’s temporality, Dasein hands down to itself its own historical “heritage,” namely, the possibilities of being that have come down to it. As authentically temporal, Dasein is thus authentically historical. The repetition of the possibilities of existence, of that which has been, is for Heidegger constitutive for the phenomenon of original history which is rooted in temporality.

4. The Quest for the Meaning of Being

Throughout his long academic career, Heidegger was preoccupied with the question of the meaning of being. His first formulation of this question goes as far back as his high school studies, during which he read Franz Brentano’s book On the Manifold Meaning of Being in Aristotle. In 1907, the seventeen-year-old Heidegger asked: “If what-is is predicated in manifold meanings, then what is its leading fundamental meaning? What does being mean?” The question of being, unanswered at that time, becomes the leading question of Being and Time twenty years later. Surveying the long history of the meaning attributed to “being,” Heidegger notes that in the philosophical tradition it has generally been presupposed that being is at once the most universal concept, the concept indefinable in terms of other concepts, and the self-evident concept. In short, it is a concept that is mostly taken for granted. However, Heidegger claims that even though we seem to understand being, its meaning is still veiled in darkness. Therefore, we need to restate the question of the meaning of being.

In accordance with the method of philosophy which he employs in his fundamental treatise, before attempting to provide an answer to the question of being in general, Heidegger sets out to answer the question of the being of the particular kind of entity that is the human being, which he calls Dasein. The vivid phenomenological descriptions of Dasein’s being-in-the-world, especially Dasein’s everydayness and resoluteness toward death, have attracted many readers with interests related to existential philosophy, theology, and literature. The basic concepts such as temporality, understanding, historicity, repetition, and authentic or inauthentic existence were carried over into and further explored in his later works.  Still, from the point of view of the quest for the meaning of being, Being and Time was a failure and remained unfinished. As Heidegger himself admitted in his later essay, “Letter on Humanism” (1946), the third division of its first part, entitled “Time and Being,” was held back “because thinking failed in adequate saying of the turning and did not succeed with the help of the language of metaphysics.” The second part also remained unwritten.

“The turn” (Kehre) that occurs in the 1930’s is the change in Heidegger’s thinking mentioned above.  The consequence of “the turn” is not the abandoning of the leading question of Being and Time.  Heidegger stresses the continuity of his thought over the course of the change. Nevertheless, as “everything is reversed,” even the question concerning the meaning of Being is reformulated in Heidegger’s later work. It becomes a question of the openness, that is, of the truth, of being. Furthermore, since the openness of being refers to a situation within history, the most important concept in the later Heidegger becomes the history of being.

For a reader unacquainted with Heidegger’s thought, both the “question of the meaning of being” and the expression “history of being” sound strange. In the first place, such a reader may argue that when something is said to be, there is nothing expressed which the word “Being” could properly denote. Therefore, the word “being” is a meaningless term and the Heideggerian quest for the meaning of being is in general a misunderstanding. Secondly, the reader may also think that the being of Heidegger is no more likely to have a history than the being of Aristotle, so the “history of being” is a misunderstanding as well. Nevertheless, Heidegger’s task is precisely to show that there is a meaningful concept of being. “We understand the ‘is’ we use in speaking,” he claims, “although we do not comprehend it conceptually.” Therefore, Heidegger asks: Can being then be thought? We can think of beings: a table, my desk, the pencil with which I am writing, the school building, a heavy storm in the mountains . . . but being? If the being whose meaning Heidegger seeks seems so elusive, almost like no-thing, it is because it is not an entity. It is not something; it is not a being. “Being is essentially different from a being, from beings.” The “ontological difference,” the distinction between being (das Sein) and beings (das Seiende), is fundamental for Heidegger. The forgetfulness of being that, according to him, occurs in the course of Western philosophy amounts to the oblivion of this distinction.

The conception of the history of being is of central importance in Heidegger’s thought. Already in Being and Time its idea is foreshadowed as “the destruction of the history of ontology.” In Heidegger’s later writings the story is considerably recast and called the “history of being” (Seinsgeschichte). The beginning of this story, as told by Heidegger especially in the Nietzsche lectures, is the end, the completion of philosophy by its dissolution into particular sciences and nihilism—questionlessness of being, a dead end into which the West has run. Heidegger argues that the question of being would still provide a stimulus to the research of Plato and Aristotle, but it was precisely with them that the original experience of being of the early Greeks was covered over. The fateful event was followed by the gradual slipping away of the distinction between being and beings. Described variously by different philosophers, being was reduced to a being: to idea in Plato, substantia and actualitas in Medieval philosophy, objectivity in modern philosophy, and will to power in Nietzsche and contemporary thought. The task which the later Heidegger sets before himself is then to make a way back into the primordial beginning, so that the “dead end” can be replaced by a new beginning. And since the primordial beginning of western thought lies in ancient Greece, in order to solve the problems of contemporary philosophy and reverse the course of modern history, Heidegger ultimately turns for help to the Presocratics, the first western thinkers.

5. Overcoming Metaphysics

For the later Heidegger, “western philosophy,” in which there occurs forgetfulness of being, is synonymous with “the tradition of metaphysics.” Metaphysics inquires about the being of beings, but in such a way that the question of being as such is disregarded, and being itself is obliterated. The Heideggerian “history of being” can thus be seen as the history of metaphysics, which is the history of being’s oblivion. However, looked at from another angle, metaphysics is also the way of thinking that looks beyond beings toward their ground or basis. Each metaphysics aims at the fundamentum absolutum, the ground of such a metaphysics which presents itself indubitably. In Descartes, for example, the fundamentum absolutum is attained through the “Cogito” argument. Cartesian metaphysics is characterized by subjectivity because it has its ground in the self-certain subject. Furthermore, metaphysics is not merely the philosophy which asks the question of the being of beings. At the end of philosophy—i.e., in our present age where there occurs the dissolution of philosophy into particular sciences—the sciences still speak of the being of what-is as a whole. In the wider sense of this term, metaphysics is thus, for Heidegger, any discipline which, whether explicitly or not, provides an answer to the question of the being of beings and of their ground. In medieval times such a discipline was scholastic philosophy, which defined beings as entia creatum (created things) and provided them with their ground in ens perfectissimum (the perfect being), God. Today the discipline is modern technology, through which the contemporary human being establishes himself in the world by working on it in the various modes of making and shaping. Technology forms and controls the human position in today’s world. It masters and dominates beings in various ways.

“In distinction from mastering beings, the thinking of thinkers is the thinking of being.” Heidegger believes that early Greek thinking is not yet metaphysics. Presocratic thinkers ask the question concerning the being of beings, but in such a way that being itself is laid open. They experience the being of beings as the presencing (Anwesen) of what is present (Anwesende). Being as presencing means enduring in unconcealment, disclosing. Throughout his later works Heidegger uses several words in order rightly to convey this Greek experience. What-is, what is present, the unconcealed, is “what appears from out of itself, in appearing shows itself , and in this self-showing manifests.” It is the “emerging arising, the unfolding that lingers.” He describes this experience with the Greek words phusis (emerging dominance) and alêtheia (unconcealment). He attempts to show that the early Greeks did not “objectify” beings (they did not try to reduce them to an object for the thinking subject), but they let them be as they were, as self-showing rising into unconcealment. They experienced the phenomenality of what is present, its radiant self-showing. The departure of Western philosophical tradition from concern with what is present in presencing, from this unique experience that astonished the Greeks, has had profound theoretical and practical consequences.

According to Heidegger, the experience of what is present in presencing signifies the true, unmediated experience of “the things themselves” (die Sache selbst). We may recall that the call to “the things themselves” was included in the Husserlian program of phenomenology. By means of phenomenological description Husserl attempted to arrive at pure phenomena and to describe beings just as they were given independently of any presuppositions. For Heidegger, this attempt has, however, a serious drawback. Like the tradition of modern philosophy preceding him, Husserl stood at the ground of subjectivity. The transcendental subjectivity or consciousness was for him “the sole absolute being.” It was the presupposition that had not been accounted for in his program which aimed to be presuppositionless. Consequently, in Heidegger’s view, the Husserlian attempt to arrive at pure, unmediated phenomena fails. Husserl’s phenomenology departs from the original phenomenality of beings and represents them in terms of the thinking subject as their presupposed ground. By contrast, Heidegger argues, for the Presocratics, beings are grounded in being as presencing. Being, however, is not a ground. To the early Greeks, being, unlimited in its dis-closure, appears as an abyss, the source of thought and wonder. Being calls everything into question, casts the human being out of any habitual ground, and opens before him the mystery of existence.

The departure of western philosophical tradition from what is present in presencing results in metaphysics. Heidegger believes that today’s metaphysics, in the form of technology and the calculative thinking related to it, has become so pervasive that there is no realm of life that is not subject to its dominance. It imposes its technological-scientific-industrial character on human beings, making it the sole criterion of the human sojourn on earth. As it ultimately degenerates into ideologies and worldviews, metaphysics provides an answer to the question of the being of beings for contemporary men and women, but skillfully removes from their lives the problem of their own existence. Moreover, because its sway over contemporary human beings is so powerful, metaphysics cannot be simply cast aside or rejected. Any direct attempt to do so will only strengthen its hold. Metaphysics cannot be rejected, canceled or denied, but it can be overcome by demonstrating its nihilism. In Heidegger’s use of the term, “nihilism” has a very specific meaning. It refers to the forgetfulness of being. What remains unquestioned and forgotten in metaphysics is Being; hence, it is nihilistic.

According to Heidegger, Western humankind in all its relations with beings is sustained by metaphysics. Every age, every human epoch, no matter however different they may be—

Greece after the Presocratics, Rome, the Middle Ages, modernity—has asserted a metaphysics and, therefore, is placed in a specific relationship to what-is as a whole. Metaphysics inquires about the being of beings, but it reduces being to a being; it does not think of being as being. Insofar as being itself is obliterated in it, metaphysics is nihilism. The metaphysics of Plato is no less nihilistic than that of Nietzsche. Consequently, Heidegger tries to demonstrate the nihilism of metaphysics in his account of the history of being, which he considers as the history of being’s oblivion. His attempt to overcome metaphysics is not based on a common-sense positing of a different set of values or the setting out of an alternative worldview, but rather is related to his concept of history, the central theme of which is the repetition of the possibilities for existence. This repetition consists in thinking being back to the primordial beginning of the West—to the early Greek experience of being as presencing—and repeating this beginning, so that the Western world can begin anew.

6. From the First Beginning to the New Beginning

Many scholars perceive something unique in the Greek beginning of philosophy. It is commonly acknowledged that Thales and his successors asked generalized questions concerning what is as a whole, and proposed general, rational answers which were no longer based on a theological ground. However, Heidegger does not associate the unique beginning with the alleged discovery of rationality and science. In fact, he claims that both rationality and science are later developments, so that they cannot apply to Presocratic thought. In his view, the Presocratics ask: “What are beings as such as a whole?” and they answer: aletheia—unconcealment. They experience beings in their phenomenality: as what is present in presencing. But the later thought which begins with Plato and Aristotle is unable to keep up with the beginning. With Plato and Aristotle metaphysics begins and the history of being’s oblivion originates.

The aim which the later Heidegger sets before himself is precisely to return to the original experience of beings in being that stands at the beginning of Western thought. This unmediated experience of beings in their phenomenality can be variously described: what is present in presencing, the unconcealment of what is present, the original disclosure of beings. To repeat the primordial beginning more originally in its originality means to bring us back to the Presocratic experiences, to dis-close them, and to let them be as they originally are. But the repetition is not for the sake of the Presocratics themselves. Heidegger’s work is not a mere antiquarian, scholarly study of early Greek thinking, nor is it an affirmation of the long lost Greek way of life. It occurs within the perspective of nihilism and being’s forgetfulness, both unknown to the Greeks, and has as a goal the future possibilities for existence. It happens as the listening that opens itself out to the words of the Presocratics from our contemporary age, from the age of the world picture and representation, the world which is marked by the domination of technology and the oblivion of being. In the first beginning, the task of the Greeks was to ask the question “What are beings?,” and hence to bring beings as such as a whole to the first recognition and the most simple interpretation. In the end, the task is to make questionable what at the end of a long tradition of philosophy-metaphysics has been forgotten. The new beginning begins thus with the question of being.

From Being and Time (1927) where the question of the meaning of being is first developed, but still expressed in the language of metaphysics, to “Time and Being” (1962) where an attempt to think being without regard to metaphysics is made, Heidegger goes full circle. Heidegger begins by asking about the multiple meanings of being and ends up conceding its multiplicity and acknowledging that there are multiple determinations or meanings of being in which being discloses itself in history. Nevertheless, in neither of these meanings does being give itself fully. “As it discloses itself in beings, being withdraws.” There is an essential withdrawal of being. Therefore, the truth of being is none of its particular historical determinations—idea, substantia, actualitas, objectivity or the will to power. The truth of being can be defined as the openness, the free region which always out of sight provides the space of play for the different determinations of being and human epochs established in them. It is that which is before actual things and grants them a possibility of manifestation as what is present, ens creatum, and objects.

The truth of being, its openness, is for Heidegger not something which we can merely consider or think of. It is not our own production. It is where we always come to stand. We find ourselves thrown in a historically conditioned environment, in an epoch in which the decision concerning the prevailing interpretation of the being of being is already made for us. Yet, by asking the question of being, we can at least attempt to free ourselves from our historical conditioning. Heidegger’s program expressed in “The End of Philosophy and the Task of Thinking” (1964) consists solely in the character of thinking which does not attempt to dominate, but engages in disclosing and opening up what shows itself, emerges, and is manifest. When Heidegger urges us to stand in being, he does not merely ask us to acknowledge our own place in being’s history, but to be future-oriented and see the future in a unity with the past as having-been and the present. It means turning oneself into being in its disclosing withdrawal.

7. From Philosophy to Political Theory

Heidegger never claimed that his philosophy was concerned with politics. Nevertheless, there are certainly some political implications of his thought. He perceives the metaphysical culture of the West as a continuity. It begins with Plato and ends with modernity, and the dominance of science and technology. He thus implies in the post-modernist fashion that Nazism and the atom bomb, Auschwitz and Hiroshima, have been something like the “fulfillment” of the tradition of Western metaphysics and tries to distance himself from that tradition. He turns to the Presocratics in order to retrieve a pre-metaphysical mode of thought that would serve as a starting point for a new beginning. However, his grand vision of the essential history of the West and of western nihilism can be questioned. Modernity, whose development involves not only a technological but also a social revolution, which sets individuals loose from religious and ethnic communities, from parishes and family bonds, and which affirms materialistic values, can be regarded as a radical departure from earlier classical and Christian traditions. Contrary to Heidegger’s argument, rather than being a mere continuity, the “essential” history of the West can then be seen as a history of radical transformations. Christianity challenges the classical world, while assimilating some aspects of it, and is in turn challenged by modernity. Modernity overturns the ideas and values of the traditional (Christian and classical) culture of the West, and, once it becomes global, leads to the erosion of nonwestern traditional cultures.

Under the cover of immense speculative depth and rich ontological vocabulary full of intricate wordplay (both which make his writings extremely hard to follow) Heidegger expresses a simple political vision. He is a revolutionary thinker who denies the traditional philosophical division between theory and practice, and this is especially clear when he boldly declares in his Introduction to Metaphysics that “we have undertaken the great and lengthy task of demolishing a world that has grown old and of building it truly anew”. He wants to overturn the traditional culture of the West and build it anew on the basis of earlier traditions in the name of being. Like other thinkers of modernity, he adopts a Eurocentric perspective and sees the revival of German society as a condition for the revival of Europe (or the West), and that of Europe as a condition for the revival of for the whole world; like them, while rejecting God as an end, he attempts to set up fabricated ends for human beings. Ultimately, in the famous interview with Der Spiegel, he expresses his disillusionment with his project and says: “Philosophy will not be able to bring about a direct change of the present state of the world . . . The greatness of what is to be thought is too great.” Like being, which he describes as “disclosing self-concealing,” after making a disclosure he withdraws; after stirring up a revolution, he leaves all its problems to others. He says: “only a God can still save us,” but the God for whom, in the absence of philosophical thought, he now looks is clearly not that of the Christians or of any contemporary religion.

In the Spiegel interview Heidegger tells us that in order to begin anew, we need to go to the “age-old” (i.e., pre-classical and pre-metaphysical) traditions of thought. He invokes the concept of the ancient polis. Yet, since he does not want to concern himself with the question of ethics (beyond saying in the “Letter of Humanism” that the word “ethics appeared for the first time in the school of Plato” and thus implying that ethics does not think the truth of being and is nihilistic), he does not consider the fact that even in pre-Platonic and pre-Socratic times a Greek polis was an ethical community, in which moral questions were raised and discussed. The Iliad and Odyssey of Homer, the poems of Hesiod, and the tragedies of Sophocles, as well as the other ancient Greek texts, including the monumental political work of Thucydides, the History of the Peloponnesian War, express concerns with ethical behavior at both the individual and community levels. Furthermore, the strength of Western civilization, insofar as its roots can be traced to ancient Greece, is that from its beginning it was based on rationality, understood as free debate, and the affirmation of fundamental moral values. Whenever it turned to irrationality and moral relativism, as in Nazism and Communism, that civilization was in decline. Therefore, Heidegger is likely to be mistaken in his diagnosis of the ills of the contemporary society, and his solution to those ills seems to be wrong. Asking the question of being (and, drawing our attention to this question is certainly his significant contribution) is an important addition to, but never a replacement for asking moral questions in the spirit of rationality and freedom.

Heidegger claims that the human being as Da-sein can be understood as the “there” (Da) which being (Sein) requires in order to disclose itself. The human being is the unique being whose being has the character of openness toward Being. But men and women can also turn away from being, forget their true selves, and thus deprive themselves of their humanity. This is, in Heidegger’s view, the situation of contemporary humans, who have replaced authentic questioning concerning their existence with ready-made answers served up by ideologies, the mass media, and overwhelming technology. Consequently, Heidegger attempts to bring today’s men and women back to the question of being. At the beginning of the tradition of Western philosophy, the human being was defined as animal rationale, the animal endowed with reason. Since then, reason has become an absolute value which through education brings about a gradual transformation of all spheres of human life. It is not more reason in the modern sense of calculative thinking, Heidegger believes, that we need today, but more openness toward and more reflection on that which is nearest to us—being.

8. Heidegger’s Collected Works

Heidegger’s earlier publications and transcripts of his lectures are being brought out in Gesamtausgabe, the complete edition of his works. The Gesamtausgabe, which is not yet complete and projected to fill about one hundred volumes, is published by Vittorio Klostermann, Frankfurt am Main. The series consists of four divisions: (I) Published Writings 1910-1976; (II) Lectures from Marburg and Freiburg, 1919-1944; (III) Private Monographs and Lectures, 1919-1967; (IV) Notes and Fragments. Below there is a list of the collected works of Martin Heidegger. English translations and publishers are cited with each work translated into English.

a. Published Writings, 1910-1976

• Frühe Schriften (1912-16).
• Sein und Zeit (1927). Translated as Being and Time by John Macquarrie and Edward Robinson (Oxford: Basil Blackwell, 1978).
• Kant und das Problem der Metaphysik (1929). Translated as Kant and the Problem of Metaphysics, by Richard Taft (Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1997).
• Erläuterungen zu Hölderlins Dichtung (1936-68). Translated as Elucidations of Hölderlin’s Poetry, by Keith Hoeller (Amherst, New York: Humanity Books, 2000).
• Holzwege (1935-46).
  • “Der Ursprung der Kunstwerkes.” Translated as “The Origin of the Work of Art,” by Albert Hofstadter, in Poetry, Language, Thought (New York: Harper & Row, 1971), and in Basic Writings (New York: Harper & Row, 1977, 1993).
  • “Die Zeit des Weltbildes.” Translated as “The Age of the World Picture” by William Lovitt in The Question Concerning Technology and Other Essays (NewYork: Harper & Row, 1977).
  • “Hegels Begriff der Erfahrung.”
  • “Nietzsches Wort ‘Gott ist tot’.” Translated as “The Word of Nietzsche: ‘God Is Dead’” by William Lovitt in The Question Concerning Technology and Other Essays.
  • “Wozu Dichter?.” Translated as “What Are Poets For?” by Albert Hofstadter, in Poetry, Language, Thought.
  • “Der Spruch der Anaximander.” Translated as “The Anaximander Fragment” by David F. Krell and Frank A. Capuzzi in Early Greek Thinking (New York: Harper & Row, 1975).
• Vol. I, Nietzsche I (1936-39). Translated as Nietzsche I: The Will to Power as Art by David F. Krell (New York: Harper & Row, 1979)
• Vol. II, Nietzsche II (1939-46). Translated as “The Eternal Recurrence of the Same” by David F. Krell in Nietzsche II: The Eternal Recurrence of the Same (New York, Harper & Row, 1984).
• Vorträge und Aufsätze (1936-53).
  • “Die Frage nach der Technik.” Translated as “The Question Concerning Technology” by William Lovitt in The Question Concerning Technology and Other Essays.
  • “Wissenschaft und Besinnung.” Translated as “Science and Reflection” by William Lovitt in The Question Concerning Technology and Other Essays.
  • “Überwindung der Metaphysik.” Translated as “Overcoming Metaphysics” by Joan Stambaugh in The End of Philosophy (New York: Harper & Row, 1973).
  • “Wer ist Nietzsches Zarathustra.” Translated as “Who is Nietzsche’s Zarathustra?” by David F. Krell in Nietzsche II: The Eternal Recurrence of the Same.
  • “Bauen Wohnen Denken.” Translated as “Building Dwelling Thinking.”
  • “Das Ding.” Translated as “The Thing” by Albert Hofstadter, in Poetry, Language, Thought.
  • “…dichterisch wohnet der Mensch...” Translated as “…Poetically Man Dwells…” by Albert Hofstadter, in Poetry, Language, Thought.
  • “Logos.” Translated as “Logos (Heraclitus, Fragment B 50)” by David F. Krell and Frank A. Capuzzi in Early Greek Thinking.
  • “Moira.” Translated as “Moira (Parmenides VIII, 34-41)” by David F. Krell and Frank A. Capuzzi in Early Greek Thinking.
  • “Aletheia.” Translated as “Aletheia (Heraclius, Fragment B 16)” by David F. Krell and Frank A. Capuzzi in Early Greek Thinking.
• Was heisst Denken? (1951-52). Translated as What Is Called Thinking? by Fred D. Wieck and J. Glenn Gray (New York: Harper & Row, 1968).
• Wegmarken (1919-58). Translated as Pathmarks. Edited by William McNeill (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1998).
  • Contains: “Comments on Karl Jaspers’ Psychology of Worldviews” (1919/21), “Phenomenology and Theology” (1927), “From the Last Marburg Lecture Course” (1928), “What is Metaphysics?” (1929), “On the Essence of Ground” (1929), “On the Essence of Truth” (1930), “Plato’s Doctrine of Truth” (1931-1932, 1940), “On the Essence and Concept in Aristotle’s Physics B 1” (1939), “Postscript to ‘What is Metaphysics?’” (1943); “Letter on Humanism” (1946), “Introduction to ‘What is Metaphysics?’” (1949), “On the Question of Being” (1955), “Hegel and the Greeks” (1958), “Kant’s Thesis About Being” (1961).
• Der Satz vom Grund (1955-56). Translated as The Principle of Reason by Reginald Lilly (Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1991).
• Identität und Differenz (1955-57). Translated as Identity and Difference by Joan Stambaugh (New York: Harper & Row, 1969).
• Unterwegs zur Sprache (1950-59). Translated as On the Way to Language by Peter D. Hertz (New York: Harper & Row, 1971).
• Aus der Erfahrung des Denkens (1910-76).
• Zur Sache des Denkens (1962-64). Translated as On Time and Being by Joan Stambaugh (New York: Harper & Row, 1972). Contains: “Time and Being,” “The End of Philosophy and the Task of Thinking,” and “My Way to Phenomenology.”
• Seminare (1951-73).
• Reden und andere Zeugnisse eines Lebensweges (1910-1976).

b. Lectures from Marburg and Freiburg, 1919-1944

• Der Beginn der neuzeitlichen Philosophie (winter semester, 1923-1924).
• Aristoteles: Rhetorik (summer semester, 1924).
• Platon: Sophistes (winter semester, 1924-1925). Translated as Plato’s Sophist by Richard Rojcewicz and Andre Schuwer (Bloomington, Indiana University Press, 1997).
• Prolegomena zur Geschite des Zeitbegriffs (summer semester, 1925). Translated as History of the Concept of Time by Theodore Kisiel (Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1985).
• Logik: Die frage nach der Wahrheit (winter semester 1925-1926).
• Grundbegriffe der antiken Philosophie (summer semester 1926).
• Geschichte der Philosophie von Thomas v. Aquin bis Kant (winter semester 1926-1927).
• Die Grundprobleme der Phänomenologie (summer semester 1927). Translated as The Basic Problems of Phenomonology by Albert Hofstadter (Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1982).
• Phänomenologie Interpretation von Kants Kritik der reinen Vernunft (winter semester 1927-1928). Translated as Phenomenological Interpretations of Kant’s Critique of Pure Reason by Parvis Emad and Kenneth Maly (Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1997).
• Metaphysische Anfangsgründe der Logik im Ausgang von Leibniz (summer semester, 1928). Translated as The Metaphysical Foundations of Logic by Michael Heim (Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1984).
• Einleitung in die Philosophie (winter semester 1928-1929).
• Der Deutsche Idealismus (Fichte, Hegel, Schelling) und die philosophische Problemlage der Gegenwart (summer semester, 1929).
• Die Grundbegriffe der Metaphysik: Welt-Endlichkeit-Einsamkeit (winter semester, 1929-1930). Translated as The Fundamental Concepts of Metaphysics by William McNeill and Nicholas Walker (Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1995).
• Vom Wesen der menschlichen Freiheit. Einleitung in die Philosophie (summer semester, 1930).
• Hegels Phänomenologie des Geistes (winter semester, 1930-1931). Translated as Hegel’s Phenomenology of Spirit by Parvis Emad and Kenneth Maly (Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1988).
• Aristoteles: Metaphysik IX (summer semester, 1931). Translated as Aristotle’s Metaphysics Theta 1-3 On the Essence and Actuality of Force by Walter Brogan and Peter Warnek (Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1995).
• Vom Wesen der Wahrheit. Zu Platons Höhlengleichnis und Theätet (winter semester, 1931-1932).
• Der Anfang der abendländischen Philosophie (Anaximander und Parmenides) (summer semester, 1932).
• Sein und Wahrheit (winter semester, 1933-1934).
• Logik als die Frage nach dem Wesen der Sprache (summer semester, 1934).
• Hölderlins Hymnen “Germanien” und “Der Rhein” (winter semester, 1934-1935).
• Einführung in die Metaphysik (summer semester, 1935). Translated as An Introduction to Metaphysics by Gregory Fried and Richard Polt (New Haven, Conn.: Yale University Press, 2000).
• Die Frage nach dem Ding. Zu Kants Lehre von den transzendentalen Grundsätzen. (winter semester, 1935-1936). Translated as What Is a Thing by W. B. Barton, Jr. and Vera Deutsch, (Chicago: Henry Regnery Company, 1967).
• Schelling: Vom Wesen der menschlichen Freiheit (1809) (summer semester, 1936). Translated as Schelling’s Treatise on the Essence of Human Freedom by Joan Stambaugh, (Athens: Ohio University Press, 1984).
• Nietzsche: Der Wille zur Macht als Kunst (winter semester, 1936-1937). Translated as Nietzsche I: The Will to Power as Art by David F. Krell (New York, Harper & Row, 1979).
• Nietzsches Metaphysische Grundstellung im abendländischen Denken: Die ewige Wiederkehr des Gleichen (summer semester, 1937). Translated as “The Eternal Recurrence of the Same” in Nietzsche II: The Eternal Recurrence of the Same by David F. Krell (New York: Harper & Row, 1984).
• Grundfragen der Philosophie. Ausgewählte “Probleme” der “Logik” (winter semester, 1937-1938). Translated as Basic Questions of Philosophy by Albert Hofstadter (Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1982).
• Nietzsches II. Unzeitgemässe Betrachtung (winter semester, 1938-1939).
• Nietzsches Lehre vom Willen zur Macht als Erkenntnis (summer semester, 1939). Translated as “The Will to Power as Knowledge” in Nietzsche III: The Will to Power as Knowledge and Metaphysics by Joan Stambaugh (New York, Harper & Row, 1987).
• Nietzsche: Der europäische Nihilismus (second trimester, 1940).
• Die Metaphysik des deutschen Idealismus. Zur erneuten auslegung von Schelling: Philosophische untersuchungen ueber das Wesen der menschlichen Freiheit und die damit zusammenhaengenden Gegenstaende (1809) (first trimester, 1941).
• Nietzsches Metaphysik (1941-2). Einleitung in die Philosopie – Denken und Dichten (1944-5).
• Grundbegriffe (summer semester, 1941). Translated as Basic Concepts by Gary Aylesworth (Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1993).
• Hölderlins Hymne “Andenken” (winter semester, 1941-1942).
• Hölderlins Hymne “Der Ister” (summer semester, 1942). Translated as Hölderlin’s Hymn “The Ister” by William McNeill and Julia Davis (Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1996).
• Parmenides (winter semester, 1942-1943). Translated as Parmenides by Andre Schuwer and Richard Rojcewicz (Bloomington, Indiana University Press, 1992).
• Heraklit. 1. Der Anfang des abendländischen Denkens (Heraklit). (summer semester, 1943); 2. Logik. Heraklits Lehre vom Logos (summer semester, 1944).
• Zur Bestimmung der Philosophie (1919).
• Grundprobleme der Phänomenologie (winter semester, 1919-1920).
• Phaenomenologie der Anschauung und des Ausdrucks. Theorie der philosophischen Begriffsbildung (summer semester, 1920).
• Phänomenologie des religiösen Lebens (summer semester, 1921).
• Phänomenologische Interpretationen zu Aristoteles: Einführung in die phänomeno-logische Forschung (winter semester, 1921-1922).
• Phänomenologische Interpretationen ausgewählter Abhandlungen des Aristoteles zur Ontologie und Logik. (summer semester, 1922).
• Ontologie: Hermeneutik der Faktizität (summer semester, 1923). Translated as Ontology: The Hermeneutics of Facticity by John va Buren (Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1999).

c. Private Monographs and Lectures, 1919-1967

• Der Begriff der Zeit (1924). Translated as The Concept of Time by William McNeill, (Oxford: Blackwell, 1992).
• Beiträge zur Philosophie (Vom Ereignis) (1936-1938). Translated as Contributions to Philosophy: (From Enowning) by Parvis Emad and Kenneth Maly (Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1999).
• Besinnung.
• Metaphysik und Nihilismus. Die Überwindung derMetaphysik. Das Wesen des Nihilismus.
• Hegel. Die Negativität. Eine Auseinandersetzung mit Hegel aus dem Ansatz in der Negativität (1938-1939, 1941). 2 Erläuterung der “Einleitung” zu Hegels “Phänomenologie des Geistes” (1942).
• Die Geschichte des Seyns (1938-1940).
• Das Ereignis (1941)
• Wahrheitsfrage als Vorfrage. Die Aletheia: Die Erinnerung in den ersten Anfang; Entmachtung der Ousis (1937).
• Zu Hölderlin – Griechenlandreisen.
• Feldweg-Gespräche. (1944-1945)
• Bremer und Freiburger Vortraege.
• Vorträge Vom Wesen der Wahrheit Freiburg lecture (1930). Der Ursprung der Kunstwerkes (1935).
• Gedachtes.
• Anmerkungen zu “Vom Wesen des Grundes” (1936). Eine Auseinandersetzung mit “Sein und Zeit” (1936). Laufende Anmerkungen zu Sein und Zeit (1936).
• Marburger Übungen. Auslegungen der Aristotelischen “physik”.
• Leibniz-Übungen.

d. Notes and Fragments

• Vom Wesen der Sprache
• Übungen SS 1937. Neitzsches metaphysische Grundstellung. Sein und Schein (1937)
• Einübung in das Denken. Die metaphysischen Grundstellungen des abendländischen Denkens. Die Bedrohung der Wissenschaft.
• Überlegungen II-VI.
• Überlegungen VII-XI.
• Überlegungen XII-XV.

Author Information

W. J. Korab-Karpowicz
Email: Sopot_Plato@hotmail.com
Anglo-American University of Prague
Czech Republic