Charles Sanders Peirce: Logic

Charles Sanders Peirce (1839-1914) was an accomplished scientist, philosopher, and mathematician, who considered himself primarily a logician. His contributions to the development of modern logic at the turn of the 20^th century were colossal, original and influential. Formal, or deductive, logic was just one of the branches in which he exercized his logical and analytical talent. His work developed upon Boole’s algebra of logic and De Morgan’s logic of relations. He worked on the algebra of relatives (1870-1885), the theory of quantification (1883-1885), graphical or diagrammatic logic (1896-1911), trivalent logic (1909), higher-order and modal logics. He also contributed significantly to the theory and methodology of induction, and discovered a third kind of reasoning, different from both deduction and induction, which he called abduction or retroduction, and which he identified with the logic of scientific discovery.

Philosophically, logic became for Peirce a broad discipline with internal divisions and external architectonic relations to other parts of scientific inquiry. Logic depends upon, or draws its principles from, mathematics, phaneroscopy (=phenomenology), and ethics, while metaphysics and psychology depend upon logic. One of the most important characters of Peirce’s late logical thought is that logic becomes coextensive with semeiotic (his preferred spelling), namely the theory of signs. Peirce divides logic, when conceived as semeiotic, into (i) speculative grammar, the preliminary analysis, definition, and classification of those signs that can be used by a scientific intelligence; (ii) critical logic, the study of the validity and justification of each kind of reasoning; and (iii) methodeutic or speculative rhetoric, the theory of methods. Peirce’s logical investigations cover all these three areas.

Table of Contents

1. Logic among the Sciences
2. Logic as Semeiotic
   1. Speculative Grammar
   2. Logical Critics
      1. From Three Types of Inference to Three Stages of Inquiry
      2. Abductive Logic
      3. Deductive Logic
      4. Inductive Logic
   3. Methodeutic
3. Peirce’s Logic in Historical Perspective
4. References and Further Reading

1. Logic among the Sciences

Peirce’s idea of logic is guided by finding the location of logic in the map of the sciences. Peirce’s mature classification of the sciences (CP 1.180-202, 1903; see Brent 1987), which is a “ladder-like scheme” (MS 328, p. 20, c. 1905), takes superordinate sciences to provide principles to subordinated sciences, forming a ladder of decreasing generality.

According to Peirce’s 1903 scheme, which he as late as 1911 considered a satisfactory account (MS 675), sciences are either sciences of discovery, sciences of review, or practical sciences. Logic is a science of discovery. The sciences of discovery are divided into mathematics, philosophy and idioscopy. Mathematics studies the necessary consequences of purely hypothetical states of things. Philosophy, by contrast, is a positive science, concerning matters of fact. Idioscopy embraces more special physical and psychical sciences, and depends upon philosophy. Philosophy in turn divides into phaneroscopy, normative sciences and metaphysics. Phaneroscopy is the investigation of what Peirce calls the phaneron: whatever is present to the mind in any way. The normative sciences (aesthetic, ethics, and logic) introduce dichotomies, in that they are, in general, the investigation of what ought and what ought not to be. Metaphysics gives an account of the universe in both its physical and psychical dimensions. Since every science draws its principles from the ones above it in the classification, logic must draw its principles from mathematics, phaneroscopy, aesthetics and ethics, while metaphysics, and a fortiori psychology, draw their principles from logic (EP 2, pp. 258-262, 1903).

In sharp contrast to the logicist hypothesis, Peirce did not believe that mathematics depends upon deductive logic. On the contrary, in a sense it is deductive logic that depends upon mathematics. For Peirce, mathematics is the practice of deduction, logic its description and analysis: Peirce’s father Benjamin Peirce had defined mathematics as the science which draws necessary conclusions (B. Peirce 1870, p. 1). Hence deductive logic for Charles became the science of drawing necessary conclusions (CP 4.239, 1902). Logic cannot furnish any justification of a piece of deductive reasoning: deduction in general is in the first place mathematically, rather than logically, valid. And deductive logic is at any rate only a part of logic: “logic is the theory of all reasoning, while mathematics is the practice of a particular kind of reasoning” (MS 78, p. 4; see Haack 1993 and Houser 1993). Logic rather draws its principles from phaneroscopy, as the latter analyzes the structure of appearance but does not pronounce upon the veracity of such appearance. Logic also draws its principles from the normative sciences of ethics and esthetics (Peirce’s preferred spelling), which precede normative logic in the ladder of generality. Ethics depends on esthetics because ethics draws from esthetics the principles involved in the idea of a summum bonum, the highest good. Since ethics is the science that distinguishes good from bad conduct, it must be concerned with deliberate, self-controlled, conduct, because only by deliberate conduct is it possible to say whether the conduct is good or bad. Logic treats of a special kind of deliberate conduct, thought, and distinguishes good from bad thinking, that is, valid from invalid reasoning. Since deliberate thought is a species of deliberate conduct, logic must draw its principles form ethics (CP 5.120-50; EP 2, pp. 196-207, 1903)

Of the sciences down the ladder of generality, metaphysics and psychology come out next. Peirce had learnt from Kant that metaphysical conceptions mirror those of formal logic. Peirce’s criticism ever since the 1860s had been that Kant’s table of categories was mistaken not because he based them upon formal logic but because the formal logic that Kant had used was itself poor and ultimately wrong (see NEM 4, p. 162, 1898). The only way to arrive at a good metaphysics is to begin with a good logical theory (EP 2, pp. 30-31, 1898). Psychology, too, depends upon logic. According to Peirce, different versions of logical psychologism characterized the logics of his time, especially in Germany. Logic for Peirce considers not what or how we in fact think but how we ought to think; logic is a normative, not a descriptive, science. The validity of an argument consists in the fact that its conclusion is true, always or for the most part, when its premises are true; it has nothing to do with reference to a mind. Logical necessity is a necessity of (non-empirical) facts, not a necessity of thinking. No appeal to psychology is thereby of any aid in logic. On the contrary, it is psychology that stands in the need of a science of logic (EP 2, pp. 242-257, 1903).

2. Logic as Semeiotic

In the 1890s (MS 595, 787), Peirce divided logic into three branches: speculative grammar (also called stechiology), logical critics (or just critics) and methodeutic (also called speculative rhetoric). The division echoes the three sciences of the medieval Trivium: grammar, dialectic and rhetoric.

Perhaps the most salient character of Peirce’s logic as a whole is that in his later works (MS L 75, 1902; MS 478, 1903; MS 693, 1904; MS 640, 1909) logic is identified with semeiotic, the science and philosophy of signs and representations. Already in his early works on the theory of inference Peirce had affirmed that logic is the branch of semeiotic that treats of one particular kind of representations, namely symbols, in their reference to their objects (W1, p. 309, 1865). By the beginning of the 20^th-century, he had shifted from the idea of “logic-within-semeiotic” to that of “logic-as-semeiotic.” He thus needed to distinguish between logic in the narrow sense, which he now calls logical critics, and logic in the wide sense; the latter is made coextensive with semeiotic. “Logic, in its general sense, is, as I believe I have shown, only another name for semiotic (σημειωτική), the quasi-necessary, or formal, doctrine of signs” (CP 2.227, c.1897; cf. Fisch 1986, pp. 338-341).

According to Peirce’s mature views, an enlargement of logic to cover all varieties of signs was a valuable methodological guidance to the building of an objective, anti-psychological and formal logical theory: “The study of the provisional table of the Divisions of Signs will, if I do not deceive myself, help a student to many a lesson in logic” (MS S 46, 1906; cf. MS 283, c. 1905; MS 675-676, 1911; MS 12, 1912). Therefore, his logic contains, as a proper part of it, a study of its own scope and expansions. In homage to Thomas of Erfurt’s grammatica speculativa, which at Peirce’s times was misattributed to Duns Scotus, Peirce names this part of logic “speculative grammar.”

a. Speculative Grammar

In the 1890s Peirce regarded speculative grammar as an analysis of the nature of assertion (MS 409-8, 1894; CP 3.432, 1896, MS 787, c. 1897). Starting with the Syllabus of his 1903 Lowell Lectures (A Syllabus of Certain Topics of Logic, MS 478, MS 540), speculative grammar becomes a classification of signs. In the Syllabus Peirce defines a Sign or Representamen as

the first Correlate of a triadic relation, the second Correlate being termed its Object, and the possible Third Correlate being termed its Interpretant, by which triadic relation the possible Interpretant is determined to be the first correlate of the same triadic relation to the same Object, and for some possible Interpretant. (MS 540, CP 2.242; EP 2, p. 290).

A sign for Peirce is something that represents an independent object and which thereby brings another sign, called interpretant, to represent that object as the sign does. According to a long tradition in the history of logic, Peirce declares that the principal classes of signs that logic is concerned with are terms, propositions, and arguments. But by 1903 these three elements become parts of a larger taxonomic scheme.

Since the Syllabus and until at least 1909 Peirce continued experimenting with principles and terminologies, without however settling on any definitive division. This section presents the main principles of the Syllabus classification.

Signs are divisible by three trichotomies; first, according as the sign in itself is a mere quality, is an actual existent, or is a general law; secondly, according as the relation of the sign to its Object consists in the sign’s having some character in itself, or in some existential relation to that Object, or in its relation to an Interpretant; thirdly, according as its Interpretant represents it as a sign of possibility, or as a sign of fact, or a sign of reason. (CP 2.243, 1903)

The first trichotomy considers signs as (i) tones, when taken in their material qualities (such as the blueness of the ink), as (ii) tokens (such as any instance of the word “the”), and as (iii) general types (such as the word “the”). The second trichotomy is the best known, namely that of (i) icons, or signs that bear similarity or resemblance to their objects, (ii) indices, which have factual connections to their objects, and (iii) symbols, which have rational connections to their objects. The third trichotomy divides signs into terms, propositions, and arguments: Through his work on the logic of relatives (see § 2.b.iii.), Peirce had come to consider the terms as (i) rhemas, which are unsaturated predicates with logical bonds or subject-positions, in some ways similar to Frege’s Begriff and Russell’s propositional function; (ii) propositions, which unify subject and predicate and thus assert, or as in the Syllabus are dicisigns, signs that tell, and (iii) arguments, which embody the ultimate perfection and end of signs as a representation of facts that are signs of other facts, such as the premises being the sign of the conclusion. [Peirce’s theory of the proposition is articulated and highly original and has been thoroughly investigated in Hilpinen 1982, 1992; Ferriani 1987; Chauviré 1994; Stjernfelt 2014.]

There are cross-divisions of these three trichotomies across speculative grammar. A term or rhema is a symbol which is represented by its interpretant as an icon of its object, while a proposition or dicisign is a symbol which is represented by its interpretant as an index of its object. Arguments themselves are considered as symbols that represent their conclusion in three different ways: iconically in abduction, indexically in deduction, and symbolically in induction. (In an early cross-division proposed in 1867 these last two were interchanged. See W2, p. 58). Other outcomes of the classifications consisted in further divisions of objects and interpretants into various subtypes. [For more on Peirce’s classifications, see Weiss & Burks 1945; Short 2007, chs. 7-9; and Burch 2011.]

Grammatical taxonomy shows that there are three kinds of arguments, each manifesting a different semiotic principle. But it is up to the second branch of logic, critics, to investigate the question of logical validity and justification of such arguments. The analysis of the conditions of validity of these three kinds of reasoning is a critical, not grammatical, question.

b. Logical Critics

i. From Three Types of Inference to Three Stages of Inquiry

Logical critics is the heart of Peirce’s logic. It cover what usually goes under the name of logic proper, that is, the investigation of inference and arguments. Many 19^th-century logicians (for example, John S. Mill, George Boole, John Venn and William Stanley Jevons) took the range of logic to include deductive as well as inductive logic. As appears from the classification, the remarkable novelty of Peirce’s logical critics is that it embraces three essentially distinct though not entirely unrelated types of inferences: deduction, induction, and abduction. Initially, Peirce had conceived deductive logic as the logic of mathematics, and inductive and abductive logic as the logic of science. Later in his life, however, he saw these as three different stages of inquiry rather than different kinds of inference employed in different areas of scientific inquiry.

Peirce had formulated a definite theory of logical leading principles early in the late 1860s. His argument is roughly as follows. In any inference, we pass from some fact to some other fact that follows logically from it. The former is the premise (for in cases where there is more than one they may be colligated or compounded into one copulative premise), the latter is the conclusion.

P
∴C

The conclusion follows from the premise logically, that is, according to some leading principle, L. As logic supposes inferences to be analyzed and criticized, as soon as the logician asks what is it that warrants the passing from such premise to the conclusion she is obliged to express the leading principle L in a proposition and to lay it down as an additional premise:

P
L
∴C

This gives what Peirce calls a complete argument, in opposition to incomplete, rhetorical or enthymematic arguments. This second argument has itself its own leading principle L₁, which may again be expressed in a proposition and laid down as a further premise:

P
L
L₁
∴C

When L₁ is not a substantially different leading principle than L, then L is said to be a logical leading principle. In Peirce’s words:

This second argument has certainly itself a leading principle, although it is a far more abstract one than the leading principle of the original argument. But you might ask, why not express this new leading principle as a premise, and so obtain a third argument having a leading principle still more abstract? If, however, you try the experiment, you will find that the third argument so obtained has no more abstract a leading principle than the second argument has. Its leading principle is indeed precisely the same as that of the second argument. This leading principle has therefore attained a maximum degree of abstractness; and a leading principle of maximum abstractness may be termed a logical principle. (NEM 4, p.175, 1898)

A logical leading principle is therefore a formal or logical proposition which, when explicitly stated, adds nothing to the premises of the inference which it governs. The central question of logical critics becomes that of determining different kinds of logical leading principles.

Peirce’s initial strategy to prove that there are three and only three irreducible kinds of reasoning was to use syllogism. He gave the demonstration that the second and the third figure are reducible to the first only through the employment of the very figure that is to be reduced. The principles involved in the three syllogistic figures cannot then be reduced to a combination of other, more primitive principles, as they invariably enter as parts into the reduction proof itself. From this Peirce drew the broader conclusion that the three figures of syllogism correspond to the three kinds of inference in general: deduction corresponds to the first figure, abduction to the second, and induction to the third:

In Peirce 1878 and Peirce 1883, abduction and induction are described as inversions of a deductive syllogism. If we call the major premise of a syllogism in the first figure Rule, its minor premise Case, and its conclusion Result, then abduction may be said to be the inference of a Case from a Result and a Rule, while induction may be said to be the inference of a Rule from a Case and a Result:

Later in 1903 Peirce had come to the conclusion that the three kinds of reasoning are in fact three stages in scientific research. First comes abduction, now often also called retroduction, by which a hypothesis or conjecture that explains some surprising fact is set forth. Then comes deduction, which traces the necessary consequences of the hypothesis. Lastly comes induction, which puts those consequences to test and generalizes its conclusions.

Any inquiry is for Peirce bound to follow this pattern: abduction–deduction–induction. Each kind of inference retains its validity and modus operandi and is logically irreducible to either of the others; yet all three of them are necessary in any complete process of inquiry. Of the three methods, Peirce took deduction to be the most secure and the least fertile, while abduction is the most fertile and the least secure.

All these three departments of critics epitomize the originality of Peirce’s contributions. The following sections deals with Peirce’s abductive, deductive, and inductive logics, respectively.

ii. Abductive Logic

The central question of abductive or retroductive logic is: is there a logic of scientific discovery? If yes, what are its justification and method?

Initially, Peirce described abduction as the inference of a Case from a Rule and a Result:

Hypothesis proceeds from Rule and Result to Case; it is the formula of the […] process by which a confused concatenation of predicates is brought into order under a synthetizing predicate. (Peirce 1883, p. 145)

Its general formula is this:

Result: S is M₁ M₂ M₃ M₄
Rule: P is M₁ M₂ M₃ M₄
Case: Therefore, S is P.

A certain number of surprising facts have been observed which call for explanation, and a single predicate embracing all of them is found which would explain them. When I notice that light manifests such-and-such complicated and surprising phenomena, and I know that ether waves exhibits those same phenomena, I conclude abductively that, if light were ether waves, it would be normal for it to manifest those phenomena. This offers rational ground for the hypothesis that light is ether waves.

In 1900, Peirce began viewing this description of abduction as inadequate. What he in 1883 had called hypothesis or abduction was actually induction about characters instead of things and is therefore better to be called qualitative induction (see § 2.b.iv): its leading principle is inductive and not abductive. Abduction is no longer constrained by the syllogistic framework. Most generally, it is the non-inductive process of forming an explanatory hypothesis. In Peirce’s words, abduction “is the only logical operation which introduces any new idea” (CP 5.172, 1903). Although abduction asserts its conclusions only conjecturally, it has a definite logical form. The following has become its standard, albeit not the ultimately satisfactory, description after Peirce’s pronouncement of it in the seventh of the Harvard Lectures of 1903:

The surprising fact, C, is observed;
But if A were true, C would be a matter of course,
Hence, there is reason to suspect that A is true. (CP 5.189, 1903)

This schema reveals why abduction is also called retroduction: it is reasoning that leads from a consequent of an admitted consequence to its antecedent.

Another description of the logical form of abduction is contained in a later, unpublished manuscript:

In the inquiry, all the possible significant circumstances of the surprising phenomenon are mustered and pondered, until a conjecture furnishes some possible Explanation of it, by which I mean a syllogism exhibiting the surprising fact as necessarily following from the circumstances of its occurrence together with the truth of the conjecture as premisses. (MS 843, p. 41, 1908)

The explaining syllogism is the inversion of the 1903 formula:

If A were true, C would be observable.
A is true.
Therefore, C is observable.

One more and hitherto unknown formulation of retroduction is found in an unpublished letter to Lady Welby:

[The] “interrogative mood” does not mean the mere idle entertainment of an idea. It means that it will be wise to go to some expense, dependent upon the advantage that would accrue from knowing that Any/Some S is M, provided that expense would render it safe to act on that assumption supposing it to be true. This is the kind of reasoning called reasoning from consequent to antecedent. For it is related to the Modus Tollens thus:

Instead of “interrogatory”, the mood of the conclusion might more accurately be called “investigand”, and be expressed as follows:

It is to be inquired whether A is not true.

The reasoning might be called “Reasoning from Surprise to Inquiry..” (Peirce to Welby, July 16, 1905, LoF, pp. 907-908)

The whole course of thought, consisting in noticing the surprising phenomenon, searching for pertinent circumstances, asking a question, forming a conjecture, remarking that the conjecture appears to explain the surprising phenomenon, and adopting the conjecture as plausible, constitutes the first, abductive stage of inquiry. Nonetheless, its crucial phase is that of forming the conjecture itself. This is often described by Peirce as an act of insight, or an instinct for guessing right, or what Galileo called il lume naturale. [That Peirce actually got the phrase from Galileo has sometimes been contested. But see the story by Victor Baker in Bellucci, Pietarinen & Stjernfelt (2014) on the “Myth of Galileo.” Baker refers to Jaime Nubiola’s finding of Peirce’s copy of Galileo’s Opere that had that phrase underlined in Peirce’s hand. That fifteen volumes edition was at least in 2012 still to be found at the Robbins Library at the Department of Philosophy, Harvard University.]

However, to pronounce reasoning to be instinctive would amount to excluding it from the realm of logic. For logic only considers reasoning, and reasoning is a deliberate act subject to self-control. According to Peirce, abduction is an inference type based upon a logical principle. In its most abstract shape, such logical principle gives abduction its justification, and the justification of abduction is the bottom question of logical critics (EP 2, p. 443, 1908).

According to Peirce, abduction “consists in studying the facts and devising a theory to explain them” (CP 5.145, 1903). Its only justifications are that “if we are ever to understand things at all, it must be in that way,” and that “its method is the only way in which there can be any hope of attaining a rational explanation” (CP 2.777, 1902). The only justification for a hypothesis is that it might explain the facts. But in general, an inference is valid if its leading principle is an instance of a logical principle which is conducive to the acquisition of new information. Therefore, the logical leading principle of all abductions is that nature, in general, is explainable. To suppose something inexplicable is contrary to the principles of logic: such supposition only has the appearance of an explanation conducive to the acquisition of new information, but to really suppose something inexplicable is to renounce knowledge.

That nature is explicable is therefore the primary abduction underlining all possible abductions. Human powers of insight may well be justified also inductively, that is, as testified by the history of science. But abduction’s primary justification is abductive rather than inductive: if we are to acquire new knowledge at all, sooner or later we must reason abductively. [See Bellucci & Pietarinen 2014; Burks 1946; Fann 1970; Kapitan 1992; Kapitan 1997; Paavola 2004 for further details on Peirce’s theory of abduction or retroduction, and Ma & Pietarinen 2015 for a dynamic logic approach to Peirce’s interrogative abduction.]

Of these three stages of reasoning, abduction is the most fertile but the least secure. For this reason, Peirce affirms that abduction is the principal kind of reasoning in which, after logical critics has pronounced it valid, it remains to be inquired whether and how it is advantageous. To carry out such tasks pertains to the third branch of logic, methodeutic, which is discussed in § 2.c below.

iii. Deductive Logic

The works of George Boole and Augustus De Morgan provided the essential backdrop for Peirce’s development of deductive logic. Also Benjamin Peirce’s Linear Associative Algebra (B. Peirce 1870) influenced his son’s early development of algebraic logic of relatives. Peirce’s dissatisfaction with how Boole represented syllogisms as algebraic equations led him to develop new algebraic approaches to logic, which he did by combining Boole’s calculus (Boole 1847, 1854) with De Morgan’s treatment of relations (De Morgan 1847, 1860).

Some of Peirce’s most important contributions to the development of modern logic are highlighted below.

1867: In the paper “An Improvement in Boole’s Calculus of Logic” published in the Proceedings of the American Academy of Arts and Sciences (Peirce 1867), Peirce subscribed all operation symbols with a comma to differentiate the logical from the arithmetical interpretation. He also made Boole’s union operator inclusive rather than exclusive (he was anticipated in this by Jevons 1864). Peirce became aware of the limitations of Boole’s algebraic logic, such as that it cannot express categorical propositions (Some X is Y), so it fails to properly represent quantification.

1870: Peirce’s development of De Morgan’s theory of relations is fully exposed in his paper “Description of a Notation for the Logic of Relatives, resulting from an Amplification of the Conceptions of Boole’s Calculus of Logic” (Peirce 1870), which was communicated to the American Academy of Arts and Sciences in January 1870. In this paper, Peirce combines De Morgan’s theory with Boole’s calculus. The result is a logical algebra equivalent in expressive power to first-order predicate logic without identity. Peirce’s paper introduces a number of original innovations. Among them is a new process of logical differentiation, explained in Welsh (2012, pp.166-180). Peirce also introduces the copula of inclusion, , later also termed the sign of illation and expressed in cursive form as . Inclusion is for Peirce a wider and logically simpler concept than that of equality. This difference marks another important departure from Boole’s mathematical algebra towards new types of logical algebras. Beginning with C. I. Lewis’s (1918) comments on Peirce’s algebra, the literature has discussed whether in this 1870 paper what Peirce calls relative terms are to be equated with relations (see Merrill 1997 for a summary and further references). It appears that in the very least they are what verbs and phrases express linguistically, such as lover of___, whatever is a lover of­____, or buyer of____for____from____. Here blanks stand for nouns that are required to complete the expressions. Beginning in 1882, Peirce comes to define relative terms as classes of ordered pairs ( later understood as being relations). He denotes such terms by rhemas with blanks for expressions standing for subjects, such as ­­____is a lover of____, whatever____is a lover of­____ and so forth. Of note is that the algebra of Peirce’s 1870 paper is able to express various forms of quantification although the term “quantifier” and its modern conception was to emerge only later in his works after the early 1880s.

1880a: The long paper “On the Algebra of Logic” (Peirce 1880a), which was published in the American Journal of Mathematics, introduces a number of further developments of which the following six are listed here:

(1) The copula, expressed as a binary relation between classes of propositions,  P_i  C_i , is now understood to express the notion of the semantic consequence, namely that “every state of things in which a proposition of the class P_i is true is a state of things in which the corresponding propositions of the class C_i are true” (W4, p. 166). The binary relation here is thus a truth-functional implication. Moreover, the remarks in his Logic Notebook published in W4 (p. 216) were written in the same year and appear to be the first instance presenting variables v and f to denote the truth values true and false.

(2) A dash over a symbol is used to denote a negative of the symbol. A dash over the sign of illation in P_i  C_i  indicates the class complement. Constants ∞ and 0 are taken to mean the values of the possible and the impossible. An important modal component which Peirce would develop later on is thus emerging in this work.

(3) The totality of all that is possible is according to Peirce the “universe of discourse, and may be very limited,” that is, limited to that which “actually occurs,” rendering “everything which does not occur” impossible (W4, p. 170). The important idea of working with variable and restricted domains makes a marked difference not only to Frege who is well-known to have his logic to quantify over the entire “logical thought”, but also to Schröder, who though also working on the algebra of logic had nonetheless rendered Peirce’s 1885 (see below) algebra of logic so as to quantify, in a Fregean fashion, what Peirce had later in 1903 remarked to be “the whole universe of logical possibility” (MS 478, pp. 163-4).

(4) A new operation on relatives, which Peirce termed transaddition (º) is then introduced (W4, p.204). Taking two relatives, such as being lover of___ (l) and being servant of___ (s), their relative product ls denotes whatever is lover of a servant of___. Their transaddition l º s denotes whatever is not a lover of everything but servants of___, that is, it denotes a complement of the complements of the relative product of the two terms l and s.

(5) The 1880 paper is also the first in which the idea of a relative sum, which is the complement of the transaddition and which Peirce in 1882 will denote by the dagger (†), is employed. For example, l † s reads lover of everything but servants of___. Hence this 1880 paper marks a decisive move towards a theory of quantification which will see its emergence in his 1883 Note B in the Studies in Logic (see below) and which comes to be completed in his 1885 “Algebra of Logic” paper (see below).

(6) The 1880 paper also suggests a mathematical theory of lattices for the treatment of the algebra of logic (W4, pp. 183-188).

Arthur Prior (1958, 1964) showed that Peirce’s 1880 paper provides a complete basis for propositional logic.

1880b: In an unpublished manuscript (MS 378, Peirce 1880b) entitled “A Boolian Algebra with One Constant”, which still in 1926 was tagged “to be discarded” at the Department of Philosophy at Harvard University, Peirce reduces the number of logical operations to one constant. He states that “this notation … uses the minimum number of different signs … shows for the first time the possibility of writing both universal and particular propositions with but one copula” (W4, p.221). Peirce’s notation was later termed the Sheffer stroke, and is also well-known as the NAND operation, in Peirce’s terms the operation by which “[t]wo propositions written in a pair are considered to be both denied” (W4, p.218). In the same manuscript, Peirce also discovers what is the expressive completeness of the NOR operation, indeed today rightly recognized as the Peirce arrow.

1881: “On the Logic of Number” (Peirce 1881), published in American Journal of Mathematics and read before the National Academy of Sciences, was noted by Gerrit Mannoury (1909, pp. 51, 78) to be the first successful axiomatization of natural numbers. Shields (1981/2012) has shown Peirce’s axiom system to be equivalent to the better-known systems of Dedekind (1888) and Peano (1889). Peirce’s paper formulates, presumably for the first time, the notions of partial and total linear orders, recursive definitions for arithmetical operations, and the general definition of cardinal numbers in terms of ordinals. The paper also provides a purely cardinal definition of a finite set (Dedekind-finite) by checking whether De Morgan’s syllogism of transposed quantity is valid. [The syllogism of transposed quantity is expressed in the following mode of inference: Every Texan kills a Texan; Nobody is killed by but one person; Hence, every Texan is killed by a Texan.] Peirce then derives in this paper the latter property of finiteness from the ordinal one. Doing the converse assumes the axiom of choice.

During 1881-2, Peirce edited a book, published in 1883 and entitled Studies in Logic by Members of the Johns Hopkins University (Peirce 1883). It contained significant graduate work by his students Benjamin I. Gilman, Christine Ladd(-Franklin), Allan Marquand and Oscar Howard Mitchell. Peirce contributed to the volume a paper “A Theory of Probable Inference”, together with Note A, “A Limited Universe of Marks”, and Note B, “The Logic of Relatives.” Some developments in Mitchell’s paper as well as in Note B are worth highlighting.

Mitchell’s “On a New Algebra of Logic” was hailed by his teacher as “one of the greatest contributions that the whole history of logic can show” (MS 492; LoF, p. 225). Peirce attributed to Mitchell two major discoveries: first, the invention of the basic form of proof transformation and second, the interpretation of quantifiers in multiple dimensions, one of which is time. The former is similar to the resolution rule in logic programming, and consists of a series of insertions (by adding to premises) and erasures (by elimination of consequents). In Peirce’s words, “the passage from a premiss or premisses … to a necessary conclusion in the manner to which is alone usually called necessary reasoning, can always be reached by adding to the stated antecedents and subtracting from stated consequents, being understood that if an antecedent be itself a conditional proposition, its antecedent is of the nature of a consequent” (MS 905; LoF, pp. 731-732). The latter discovery—universes in multiple dimensions—has its correlate in the idea of interpreted domains and in the modern notion of temporal logics and many-sorted quantification. It can also be seen as a development of new languages that take the role of indices in the quantifiers to be mappings from contexts to values in universes of discourse. Having in mind Mitchell’s pioneering idea of logical dimensions, Peirce goes on to mention that the study of Mitchell’s paper was for him necessary in order to break “ground in the gamma [modal logic] part of the subject” of existential graphs (MS 467; LoF, p. 332; see below). Years later, Peirce defines the term “dimension” in the Dictionary of Philosophy and Psychology by noting that it is

an element or respect of extension of a logical universe of such a nature that the same term which is individual in one such element of extension is not so in another. Thus, we may consider different persons as individual in one respect, while they may be divisible in respect to time, and in respect to different admissible hypothetical states of things, etc. This is to be widely distinguished from different universes, as, for example, of things and of characters, where any given individual belonging to one cannot belong to another. The conception of a multidimensional logical universe is one of the fecund conceptions which exact logic owes to O. H. Mitchell. Schröder, in his then second volume, where he is far below himself in many respects, pronounces this conception ‘untenable’. But a doctrine which has, as a matter of fact, been held by Mitchell, Peirce, and others, on apparently cogent grounds, without meeting any attempt at refutation in about twenty years, may be regarded as being, for the present, at any rate, tenable enough to be held. (DPP 2, p. 27)

Mitchell develops, for the first time, the idea and the notation for existential and universal quantifiers, and notices that it is by from alternations of these quantifiers that logic derives its expressive power. Peirce testifies in the same dictionary entry that placing Σ and Π in alternating orders “was probably first introduced by O. H. Mitchell in his epoch-making paper” (DPP 2, p. 650). However, being limited to monadic predicates, Mitchell’s language was deprived of some expressive power.

Having supervised and perused Mitchell’s paper, in Note B of the Studies in Logic, Peirce generalizes the groundwork Mitchell had laid on the theory of quantification. His theory of relatives adds indices as individual variables to the operators Σ and Π to denote individual objects. Relative products and relative sums are then defined as (lb)_ij = Σx(l)_ix(b)_xj and (l † b)_ij = Π_x {(l)_ix + (b)_xj}, thus becoming species of existential and universal quantification: the lover of a benefactor is “a particular combination, because it implies the existence of something loved by its relate and a benefactor of its correlate.” The lover of everything but benefactors is “universal, because it implies the non-existence of anything except what is either loved by its relate or a benefactor of its correlate” (Peirce 1883, p. 189). Peirce had already had the relative sum at his disposal and the idea of it expressing the non-existence of exceptions naturally led to its dual of the existential quantification. Towards the end of Note B Peirce writes something is a lover of something as Σ_i Σ_aj l_ij, everything is a lover of something as Π_i Σ_j l_ij, there is something which stands to something in the relation of loving everything except benefactors of it as Σ_i Σ_k Π_j (l_ij + b_jk), and so on. Taking α to denote accuser to___of___, ε excuser to___of___, and π preferrer to___of___, Π_i Σ_j Σ_k (α)_ijk (ε_jki + π_kij) means that “having taken any individual i whatever, it is always possible so to select two, j and k, that i is an accuser to j of k, and also is either excused by j to k or is something to which j is preferred by k” (Peirce 1883, p. 201). The phrasing Peirce uses here (such as “having taken any individual”, “it is always possible so to select”) is indicative of a new semantic treatment of quantifiers and sequences of quantifiers which he goes on to pursue further in later papers, and which in Hilpinen (1982), Hintikka (1996) and Pietarinen (2006) have shown to agree with game-theoretic semantics. Interestingly, Peirce’s examples are all stated in prenex normal form, which highlights the idea of sequences of dependent quantifiers. Peirce’s quantifiers bind variables ranging over interpreted domains. In this 1883 paper, he provides the basic inference rules, such as Σ_i Π_j   Π_j Σ_i, for manipulating the strings of quantifiers. The language is not inductively defined, it lacks notation for functions, and it uses neither constants nor an equality sign, but in other respects it coincides with that of first-order predicate calculus.

Alfred Tarski’s summary concerning Peirce’s contributions to the logical theory of relatives is illuminating:

[t]he title of creator of the theory of relations was reserved for C. S. Peirce. In several papers published between 1870 and 1882, he introduced and made precise all the fundamental concepts of the theory of relations and formulated and established its fundamental laws. Thus Peirce laid the foundation for the theory of relations as a deductive discipline; moreover he initiated the discussion of more profound problems in this domain. In particular, his investigations made it clear that a large part of the theory of relations can be presented as a calculus which is formally much like the calculus of classes developed by G. Boole and W. S. Jevons, but which greatly exceeds it in richness of expression and is therefore incomparably more interesting from the deductive point of view. (Tarski 1941, p. 73)

However, it is his 1885 theory of quantification that Peirce calculated to settle the problems of deductive logic and logical analysis in a way that decidedly brought him beyond the algebraic approach to the logic of relatives.

1885: Peirce’s logic of quantifiers comes to a full blossom in his paper, written in summer 1884, “On the Algebra of Logic: A Contribution to the Philosophy of Notation”, and published in the American Journal of Mathematics in the following year (Peirce 1885). This massive paper defies any condensed exposition; but in summary, it contains Peirce’s “five icons of algebra” as a system of natural deduction based on introduction and elimination rules. Peirce had repeatedly stated that his having supervised and examined Mitchell’s paper was essential in order to arrive at the idea of these two basic operations. There is an abundant use of truth-functional propositions and an anticipation of the truth-table method to test tautologies. One of the examples comes close to the tableaux method, later proposed by Evert Beth and Jaakko Hintikka, that spells out a systematic search for counter-models by deriving contradictions from the negations of the formula to be proved. In order “to find whether a formula is necessarily true,” he says, “substitute f and v for the letters and see whether it can be supposed false by any such assignment of values” (Peirce 1885, p. 224; Pietarinen 2006; Anellis 2012a).

When he moves on to the first-order (“first-intentional”) logic, Peirce seeks to devise a notation that is as iconic as possible, building on his semiotic insight that the more iconic a notation is, the better suited it would be for logical analysis. He starts by using “Σ for some, suggesting a sum, and Π for all, suggesting a product” (1885, p. 180). Once again, Peirce credits Mitchell, now for the method of separating the “quantifying part”—which he later termed the “Hopkinsian” to honour its place of discovery (MS 515, 1902)—from the pure Boolean expression: the latter refers to an individual by its use of indices (like pronouns in language) while the former states what that individual is. The quantifying operators are, however, “only similar to a sum and product,…because the individuals of the universe may be denumerable” (1885, p. 180). Peirce’s consideration illustrates similar lines of thought as those that prompted Löwenheim to formulate his famous 1915 theorem: if a first-order sentence has a model then it has also a countable model, or generally, models for sets of formulas being of some cardinality imply models of some other infinite cardinality (Badesa 2004). (Associating infinite products and sums with conjunctions and disjunctions was what Wittgenstein took to be his own biggest mistake in logic.) The 1885 paper continues introducing rules for quantifier manipulation, including “putting the Σs to the left, as far as possible” (1885, p. 182), which is a prelude to the idea of Skolem normal forms. One could say that it is the sequences of quantifiers, especially those of dependent quantifiers, that contribute to a linear logic notation as being maximally iconic, and that it is the prenex and Skolem normal forms that bring out maximal analyticity which logical icons exploit. The 1885 paper then presents many examples drawn from natural language to be analyzed logically with this new notation. The paper also extensively deals with issues having to do with the representation of mathematical notions such as one-to-one correspondence and identity in the second-intentional logic, developed in the third part of the paper, and in which variables range over relations. There is an early attempt at axiomatizing set theory as well as some profound philosophical consideration on the possibility of developing a “method for the discovery of methods in mathematics,” which is to be based on these new approaches that aim at formulating a general theory of deductive logic.

Thanks to the volumes that have appeared in the Chronological Edition of the Writings between 1982 and 2010, and which have covered Peirce’s work up to 1892, these earlier phases of Peirce’s deductive logic are now relatively well understood. But the research from that point on has been hampered by the unavailability of systematic editions concerning Peirce’s later logical writings. Yet the mid-1890s marks only the beginnings of a new and by far the most productive era in Peirce’s logical investigations, which were to last until the last months of his life. This situation has by no means been adequately reflected in the secondary literature.

Although Peirce would continue his investigations on the algebra of logic throughout his life, the algebraic element would no longer assume a central position in his overall oeuvre:

In 1895 Schröder published the third huge volume of his logic, which consisted mainly of a vast elaboration in detail of the logical algebra of my Note B. That I never considered that algebra to be a great masterpiece is sufficiently shown by my giving my exposition of it no other title than “Note B.” The perusal of Schröder’s book convinced me that the algebra was not what was wanted, and in the Monist for January 1897 I produced a system of graphs which I now term Entitative Graphs. I shortly after abandoned that and took up Existential Graphs” (MS 467; LoF, p. 332).

Although it was Schröder’s elaboration that was to influence the works of the early model theorists such as Löwenheim and Skolem (Brady 2000), it was Peirce’s and Mitchell’s works that germinated the concept of first-order statements being true-in-a model (Pietarinen 2006; Bellucci & Pietarinen 2015a). Moreover, Peirce’s incessant hunt for new logical notations and methods was much more ambitious and philosophical than his early algebraic investigations revealed.

What was to take the place of algebra were the ideas that emerged from diagrammatic, iconic and topological considerations on logical representation and reasoning. These considerations were at first prompted by logical analogues to algebraic invariants in chemistry first developed by Peirce’s John Hopkins colleague J. J. Sylvester (1878) and investigated in Kempe (1886). Peirce was initially fascinated by the analogy in which a chemical atom is like a relative “in having a definite number of loose ends or “unsaturated bonds”, corresponding to the blanks of the relative” (CP 3.469, 1897). But the continual search for better and better notations for the overall purposes of logical analysis would also reveal the reasons why Peirce had to overcome this analogy between logic and chemistry.

Peirce’s theory of Existential Graphs (EGs), first conceived in summer 1896 and developed in subsequent years (for example Peirce 1897, 1906), was in part motivated by his need to respond to the expressive insufficiency and lack of analytic power of the systems described in his Note B, which he later termed the algebra of dyadic (dual) relatives, and in the 1885 general (universal) algebra of logic. The analytic power comes from the idea of subsuming what the algebraic operations do when composing concepts under one mode of composition. This composition of concepts is effected in the theory of EGs by the device of ligatures. A ligature is a complex line, composed of what Peirce terms the lines of identities, which connects various parts and areas of the graphs: [See e.g. Zeman 1964; Roberts 1973; Shin 2002; Dipert 2006; Pietarinen 2005, 2006, 2011, 2015a.]

Fig. 1 

Fig. 2 

Fig. 3

The meaning of these lines is that the two or more descriptions apply to the same thing. For example, in Figure 2 there is a horizontal line attached to the predicate term “is obedient.” It means that “something exists which is obedient.” There is also another line which connects to the predicate term “is a catholic,” and that composition means that “something exists which is a catholic”, which is equivalent to the graph-instance in Figure 3. Since in Figure 1 these two lines are in fact connected by a continuous line, the graph-instance in Figure 1 means that “there exists a catholic which is obedient,” that is, “there exists an obedient catholic.” Ligatures, representing continuous connections composed of two or more lines of identities, stand for quantification, identity and predication, all in one go.

These EGs are drawn on a sheet of assertion that represents what the modeller knows or what mutually has been agreed upon to be the case by those who undertake the investigation of logic. The sheet thus represents the universe of discourse. The graph that is drawn on the sheet puts forth an assertion, true or false, that there is something in the universe to which it applies. This is the reason why Peirce terms these graphs existential. Drawing a circle around the graph, or alternatively, shading the area on which the graph-instance rests, means that nothing exists of the sort of description intended. In Figure 4, the assertion “something is a catholic” is denied by drawing an oval around it and thus severing that assertion from the sheet of assertion:

Fig. 4

The graph-instance depicted in Figure 4 thus means that “something exists that is not catholic.”

Peirce aimed at a diagrammatic syntax that would use a minimal number of logical signs but at the same time be maximally expressive and as analytic as possible. His ovals, for instance, have different notational functions: “The first office which the ovals fulfill is that of negation. […] The second office of the ovals is that of associating the conjunctions of terms. […] This is the office of parentheses in algebra” (MS 430, pp. 54-56, 1902). The ovals are thus not only the diagrammatic counterpart to negation but also serve to represent the compositionality of a graph-formula. He held (MS 430, 1902; MS 670, 1911) that a notation that does not separate the sign of truth-function from the representation of its scope is more analytic than some other notation, such as that of an ordinary “symbolic” language, where such a separation is needed to force a one-dimensional notation. The role of ovals as denials is in fact a derived function from more primitive considerations of inclusion and implication (Bellucci & Pietarinen 2015; MS 300, 1908).

As to expressivity, Peirce had already recognized that the notion of dependent quantification was essential in any system expressive enough to serve the purposes of logical analysis of any assertions. The nested system of ovals in EGs effectuate this in a natural way, much in contrast to algebras that resort to an explicit use of parentheses and other punctuation devices. For example, the graph in Figure 5 means that “Every Catholic adores some woman.” The graph in Figure 6 means that “Some woman is adored by every Catholic.” Peirce notes that the latter asserts more since it states that all Catholics adore the same woman, whereas the former allows different Catholics to adore different women.

Fig. 5        

Fig. 6  

The graph in Figure 7 means that “anything whatever is unloved by something that benefits it,” that is, “everything is benefitted by something or other that does not love it”:

Fig. 7

Lastly, Figure 8 provides an example of a very complex graph taken from MS 504 (1898):

 

Fig. 8

Peirce provided the meaning in natural language this way:

Every being unless he worships some being who does not create all beings either does not believe any being (unless it be not a woman) to be any mother of a creator of all beings or else he praises that woman to every being unless to a person whom he does not think he can induce to become anything unless it be a non-praiser of that woman to every being.

It is on the level of semantics where the power of dependent quantification comes to the fore. Peirce carried the semantics out in terms of defining the basics of what today is recognized as two-player zero-sum semantic games. For Peirce these games take place between the Graphist/Utterer and the Grapheus/Interpreter. [Sometimes, especially in Peirce’s model-building games, these roles split so that the Grapheus and the Interpreter are playing separate roles, see Pietarinen 2013.] Peirce’s semantic games were not limited to EGs; he applied the same idea also to interpret quantificational expressions and connectives in his general algebra of logic.

It speaks to the superiority of EGs over algebraic systems that in it deduction, following Mitchell’s work, is reduced to a minimum number of permissive operations. Peirce termed these operations illative rules of transformation, and in effect they consist only of two: insertions (permissions to draw a graph-instance on the sheet of assertion) and erasures (permissions to erase a graph-instance from the sheet). More precisely, the oddly enclosed areas of graphs (areas within an odd number of enclosures) permit inserting any graph on that area, while evenly enclosed areas permit erasing any graph from that area. A copy of a graph-instance is permitted to be pasted on that same area or any area deeper within the same nest of enclosures (the rule of iteration), and a copy thus iterated is permitted to be erased (the converse rule of deiteration). An interpretational corollary is that the double enclosure with no intervening graphs in the middle area can be inserted and erased at will.

A more detailed exposition of these illative rules of transformation would need to show their application to quantificational expressions, namely applying insertions and erasures to ligatures. A flavor of such proofs is given by inspecting the Figures 1, 2 and 3: an application of a permissible erasure on the line of identity in Figure 1 amounts to the graph-instance in Figure 2, and that another application of a permissible erasure on the upper part of the graph-instance in Figure 2 amounts to the graph-instance depicted in Figure 3. Thus what is represented in Figure 2 is a logical consequence of the graph-instance in Figure 1, and what is represented in Figure 3 is a logical consequence of the graph-instance given in Figure 2.

Roberts (1973) was the first to prove that these transformation rules, first given by Peirce in 1898, form a semantically complete system of deduction. Roberts did not mention, however, that Peirce had demonstrated their soundness in 1898 and again in 1903 and that he had argued for their completeness in terms of what he termed the “perfect archegetic rules of transformation” in the unpublished parts of the Syllabus for the Lowell Lectures that Peirce delivered in 1903.

The polarity of the outermost ends or portions of ligatures determines whether the quantification is existential (that end or portion resting on even/positive areas) or universal (if it rests on odd/negative area). Unlike in the Tarski-type semantics, but just as what happens in game-theoretic semantics, the preferred rule of interpretation of the graphs is what Peirce termed “endoporeutic”: one looks for the outermost portions of ligatures on the sheet of assertions first, assigns semantic values to that part, and then proceeds inwards into the areas enclosed with ovals. In non-modal contexts, ligatures are not well-formed graphs because they may cross the enclosures.

The diagrammatic nature of EGs consists in the iconic relationship between forms of relations exhibited in the diagrams and the real relations in the universe of discourse. Peirce was convinced that, since these graphical systems exploit a proper diagrammatic syntax, they—together with any of their extensions that would be introduced to cover modalities, non-declarative expressions, speech acts, and so forth—can express any assertion, however intricate. Guided by the precepts laid out by the diagrammatic forms of expression, and together with the simple illative permissions by which deductive inference proceeds, the conclusions from premises can be “read before one’s eyes”; these graphs present what Peirce believed is a “moving picture of the action of the mind in thought” (MS 298; LoF, p. 655; late 1906-1907).

If upon one lantern-slide there be shown the premisses of a theorem as expressed in these graphs and then upon other slides the successive results of the different transformations of those graphs; and if these slides in their proper order be successively exhibited, we should have in them a veritable moving picture of the mind in reasoning. (MS 905; LoF, p. 723; late 1907-1908)

The theory of EGs that uses only the notation of ovals and the spatial notion of juxtaposition of graphs is termed by Peirce the Alpha part of the EGs, and it corresponds to propositional logic. The extension of the alpha part with ligatures and rhemas (also termed spots by Peirce) gives rise to the Beta part, and it corresponds to fragments of first-order predicate calculus. What Peirce termed the Gamma part was a boutique of a number of developments, including various modalities such as metaphysical, epistemic and temporal modalities, as well as extensions of such graphs with ligatures. In Peirce’s writings, there are developments of graphical systems for higher-order logics and abstraction (Peirce’s “logic of potentials”), the logic of collections, and investigation of meta-logical expressions that use the language of graphs to talk about notions and properties of the graphs in that language (Peirce’s “graphs of graphs”). He mentions late in 1911 that the Delta part would also need to be added, most likely because of the ever-expanding systems that had been mushrooming in the Gamma part.

Peirce’s further contributions to deductive logic. While the development of the theory of the logic of existential graphs was his chief contribution, Peirce’s other contributions to the development of modern logic were numerous. In the Logic Notebook (1909) he defined a number of operations for three-valued logic and gave semantics for them in terms of defining truth-tables for such new connectives (Fisch & Turquette 1966). In these systems, which he called triadic logic, the third value is “the limit” between “true” and “not true,” and it applies to what Lane (1999) has identified as boundary-propositions: in Peirce’s terms, boundary-propositions have “a lower mode of being” which can “neither be determinately P, nor determinately not-P,” but are “at the limit between P and not P” (MS 399, p. 344r, 1909). Peirce defined several connectives to realize this idea in alternative ways, including four one-place connectives which were later reinvented as strong negation, two Post negations and the Tertium function, as well as six two-place connectives, including one that pertains to the logic of ordinary discourse.

Generally, Peirce divided deduction in two: on the one hand, deduction is either necessary or probable (deductive reasoning about probabilities), and on the other hand, deduction is either corollarial or theorematic. Corollarial deduction is reasoning “where it is only necessary to imagine any case in which the premisses are true in order to perceive immediately that the conclusion holds in that case.” Theorematic deduction “is deduction in which it is necessary to experiment in the imagination upon the image of the premiss in order from the result of such experiment to make corollarial deductions to the truth of the conclusion” (MS L 75, 1902). He considered the theorematic/corollarial distinction his first real discovery in the philosophy of mathematics. Theorematic deductions can be of different kinds and degrees of complexity, and he took the classification of various types of theorematic deductions to be of the utmost value in the theory of logic (MS 617; MS 201; Peirce 1908). Stjernfelt (2014) proposes a new classification of theorematic inferences. Hintikka (1980) has argued that reasoning is theorematic if it increases the number of layers of quantifiers, and that an argument is the more theorematic the more new individuals are used in it (see also Ketner 1985; Zeman 1986; Hoffmann 2010).

Zooming into some of the details of Peirce’s systems of logic, including those of diagrammatic logics, one finds a treasury of developments the meaning of which is only beginning to unravel over a century later (Bellucci, Pietarinen & Stjernfelt 2014). In 1886, Peirce suggested in a letter to his former student Allan Marquand, who had designed mechanical logic machines for syllogistic reasoning, that “it is by no means hopeless to expect to make a machine for really difficult problems. But you would have to proceed step by step. I think electricity would be the best thing to rely on” (L 269, Peirce to Marquand, 30 December, 1886; W5, p. 422). He then showed how switching circuits can be connected serially and in parallel, noting that these two configurations correspond to multiplication (algebraic sum as logical disjunction) and addition (algebraic product as logical conjunction) in logic. In addition to the idea of real logical machines running on electricity, Peirce was also very interested in the philosophical question of whether living intelligence is required in performing deductive reasoning, an issue of continuing relevance to A.I. and to the prospects of automatized theorem proving. In 1902 he developed two notational systems with sixteen binary connectives to map out all of the possible truth functions of the binary propositional calculus (Clark 1997; Zellweger 1997). According to Max Fisch, “No other logician compares with Peirce in attention to systems of notation and to sign-creation” (Fisch 1982, p. 132). Peirce’s work on these notational systems foresaw geometrical structures of logic, including spaces revealed by the study of the geometry of negation and other operators. Based on Peirce’s conceptual and sign-theoretic considerations, an apparatus for displaying and performing a complete set of the sixteen binary connectives in a two-valued propositional logic was patented in the U.S.A. in 1981 by Shea Zellweger.

Peirce also worked on early forms of topology (Havenel 2010), including studies on what might be recognized as rudimentary versions of homologies and knots, in his attempts to find pathways not only to logical issues but also to questions in philosophy of mathematics (Murphey 1961; Moore 2010).

Moreover, his diagrammatic systems of modal logic included suggestions for defining several types of multi-modal logics in terms of tinctures of areas of graphs. Tinctures enable logic to assert, among others, modalities including necessities and metaphysical possibilities, and so call for changes in the nature of how the corresponding logics behave, including the identification of individuals at the presence of multiple universes of discourses. He defined epistemic operators in terms of subjective possibilities, which, just as in contemporary epistemic logic, are epistemic possibilities defined as duals of knowledge operators. He analyzed the meaning of identities between actual and possible objects in quantified multi-modal logics. As an example, the two graphs given in Figures 9 and 10 that he presented in a 1906 draft of the Prolegomena paper (MS 292) illustrate the nature of the interplay between epistemic modalities and quantification.

Fig. 9

Fig. 10

The graph in Figure 9 is read “There is a man who is loved by one woman and loves a woman known by the Graphist to be another.” The reason is this. In the equivalent graph depicted in Figure 10 the woman who loves is denoted by the name A, and the woman who is loved is denoted by the name B. The shaded area is a tincture that refers to the modality of subjective possibility. Thus the graph in Figure 10 means that it is subjectively impossible, by which Peirce means that “it is contrary to what is known by the Graphist” (= the modeller of the graph), that A should be B. In other words, the woman who loves and the woman who is loved (whom the graph does not assert to be otherwise known to the Graphist) are known by the Graphist not to be the same person.

Peirce’s work highlights the philosophical significance of ideas that were rediscovered later and largely after the mid-twentieth century, though often in different clothes: in Peirce’s largely unpublished works one finds him addressing such topics as multi-modal logics and possible-worlds semantics, quantification into modal contexts, cross-world identities (in MS 490 he termed these special relations connecting objects in different possible worlds (for references, see Pietarinen 2005), cumulative and branching quantifiers (the latter being related to independence-friendly logic, see Pietarinen 2015b), as well as what later on became known as “Peirce’s Puzzle” (Dekker 2001; Hintikka 2011; Pietarinen 2015b), namely the question of the meaning of indefinites in conditional sentences, which Peirce himself analyzed in quantified modal extensions of EGs.

Far from merely anticipating later discoveries, thus, Peirce’s logic in general puts what later on came to be explored in the fields of philosophical logic, formal semantics and pragmatics, philosophy of logic, mathematics, mind and language, cognitive and computing sciences, and history and philosophy of science, into a systematic logico-semeiotic perspective. From time to time, his ideas even surpass stagnated contemporary discussions, especially in the philosophy of logic and mathematics. [See for example Bellucci, Pietarinen & Stjernfelt 2014; Lupher & Adajian 2015; Sowa 2006; Zalamea 2012a; Zalamea 2012b; PM. For further details on Peirce’s deductive logic, see the collection of Houser and others, eds. 1997. Hilpinen 2004 provides a useful overview.]

iv. Inductive Logic

In 1865 (W1, pp. 263-64) Peirce defines induction as inference from Case and Result to Rule. Its general form is:

Case: M₁ M₂ M₃ M₄  are S
Result: M₁ M₂ M₃ M₄  are P
Rule: Therefore, all S are P.

A certain number of objects (M₁ M₂ M₃ M₄ ), known to belong to a certain class (S), possess a certain character (P); therefore, it can be infered inductively that the whole class S possesses that character. I notice that neat, swine, sheep, and deer, which I know are cloven-hoofed, are herbivores. Therefore, I infer inductively that all cloven-hoofed animals are herbivores.

Later, Peirce came to divide induction into three principal kinds. Crude induction is the lowest form of induction, based upon the common practice of generalizing about future events on the ground of previous experience. For example, “No instance of a genuine power of clairvoyance has ever been established: So I presume there is no such thing”; “cancer is incurable, because every known case has proved to be so.” Its general form is “All observed As are B. Therefore, All As are B.” It is the weakest form of inductive reasoning in terms of security. Qualitative induction is the intermediate kind in terms of security. It is what Peirce had earlier called hypothetical reasoning or abduction. It consists in testing a hypothesis by sampling the possible predications that may be made on the basis of it (CP 7.216). Qualitative abduction is reasoning that tests hypotheses already formulated. It should not be confused with abduction, which is reasoning that originates new hypotheses. Quantitative induction is the highest form of induction in terms of security. It investigates the real probability that a member of a certain class will have a certain character. Its procedure consists in finding a representative sample of the class and noting the proportion of them that possess the character P. Then, the inference is drawn that the proportion holds for the whole class. Its logical form is

S₁ S₂ S₃ S₄ and so forth, are taken at random from the Ms.
The proportion p of S₁ S₂ S₃ S₄ is P.
Hence, probably and approximately, the same proportion p of the Ms are P.

The inversion of a quantitative induction gives us a statistical deduction, whose form is

The proportion p of the Ms are P.
S₁ S₂ S₃ S₄ and so forth, are taken at random from the Ms.
Hence, the proportion p of them is P.

Although crude, qualitative, and quantitative induction are different in kind, their justification is, according to Peirce, the same:

The validity of Induction consists in the fact it proceeds according to a method which though it may give provisional results that are incorrect will yet if steadily pursued, eventually correct any such error. […] all Induction possesses this kind of validity, and […] no Induction possesses any other kind that is more than a further determination of this kind. (MS 293, 1907)

The validity rests upon induction being self-corrective: in the long run induction is bound to lead us ever closer to the correct representation of reality. Its validity is therefore linked to esse in futuro, to the possibility of self-correction of the very method itself. Any actual induction that is performed may well be wrong or partly wrong, but it remains valid because its leading principle is valid, that is, is conducive to truth in the long run.

Peirce’s polemic target was a theory that would make the validity of induction rest upon some principles of uniformity or regularity in nature. According to Peirce, that was how John S. Mill and Philodemus of Gadara (ca.110–ca.30 B.C.E.) attempted, unsoundly, to justify induction. Of the several objections that Peirce raised from time to time against this way of justifying induction, one is worth reporting. Mill argues that a universe without any regularity is imaginable, and that in that universe inductions would be invalid. But the absence of uniformity, that is, the absence among certain objects S of the character P, is itself a uniformity. No universe is imaginable in which induction is not valid. According to Peirce, “even if nature were not uniform, induction would be sure to find it out, so long as inductive reasoning could be performed at all” (CP 2.775).

Cheng 1969, Goudge 1946, Merrill 1975 and Forster 1989 provide further details on Peirce’s inductive logic.

c. Methodeutic

The third branch of Peirce’s logic is methodeutic, which he also called speculative rhetoric. He defined it to be “the study of the proper way of arranging and conducting an inquiry” (MS 606, p. 17), depicting it as being “not so exact in its conclusions as is critical logic” (MS L 75, 1902) and as involving “certain psychological principles” (MS 633, 1909). But it nevertheless is a theoretical study and not an art. Methodeutic is based upon critics, and considers not what is admissible (logical validity) but what is advantageous (logical economy). It is a “theoretical study of advantages” (MS L 75, 1902).

Abduction is of special interest to methodeutic, because abduction is the only mode of inference that can initiate a scientific hypothesis. But being justifiable is not a sufficient property of good hypotheses:

Any hypothesis which explains the facts is justified critically. But among justifiable hypotheses we have to select that one which is suitable for being tested by experiment. (MS L 75, 1902)

Among critically equivalent hypotheses (that is, hypotheses that explain the facts), one should be able to select for testing those that are capable of experimental verification. [Being capable of experimental verification is in Peirce’s philosophy of science to be conceived in the wide sense, including mental experimentation and imaginative activities in our thoughts (Bellucci & Pietarinen 2015b). It is not the same thing as the empirical verification criterion of the positivists, which Peirce often criticized.] This is the core of Peirce’s philosophy of pragmati(ci)sm, which teaches that the whole meaning of a hypothesis is in its conceivable practical (that is, experienceable) effects; pragmaticism therefore is “nothing else than the question of the logic of abduction” (CP 5.196, 1903).

In turn, among “pragmatistically” equivalent hypotheses (that is, hypotheses that are capable of experimental verification) one should select those that in the sense of Peirce’s economy of research are the cheapest ones. His argument for the economic character of methodeutic is roughly as follows: the logical validity of abduction presupposes that nature be in principle explainable. This means that to discover is simply to expedite an event that would sooner or later occur. Therefore, the real service of a logic of abduction is of the nature of an economy. Economy itself depends on three factors: cost (of money, time, energy, thought), the value of the hypothesis itself, and its effects upon other projects and hypotheses (MS L 75, 1902; MS 690, CP 7.164-231, 1901).

Although primarily concerned with abduction, methodeutic also has an interest in deduction and induction. Theorematic deductions (see §2.b.iii) manifest peculiar logical steps that are abductive rather than deductive. In order to overcome the lack of critical instruments for the investigation of those steps, Peirce emphasizes the need to have an inventory and logical classification of valuable steps in the history of mathematics which would become part of a methodeutic of necessary reasoning (Peirce 1908, MS 200-201).

Peirce also considered the study of the properties of different logical and mathematical notations and symbolisms as belonging to the department of methodeutic. In this respect, he coined the maxim of the ethics of terminology and of notation:

The person who introduces a conception into science has both the right and the duty of prescribing a terminology and a notation for it; and his terminology and notation should be followed except so far as it may prove positively and seriously disadvantageous to the progress of science. If a slight modification is sufficient to remove the objection, a much greater one should be avoided. (MS 530, 1902)

Induction too has its methodological side. The methods of the three classes of inductions are all based on “samples,” and they all presuppose that the samples are representative of the class from which they are sampled: methodeutic should therefore teach methods of producing fair samplings. His own experimental work is exemplary in that it develops new statistical methods to ascertain that truly randomized samples are achieved and that fully blinded testing conditions are secured. He emphasizes the method of predesignation, which prescribes that the characters concerning which class is sampled are to be chosen beforehand so that the sampler would not be influenced by any agreement among the members of the sample (see Goudge 1946).

Other things Peirce considers to pertain to methodeutic include the principles of definition, the methods of classification in general, and the doctrine of the clearness of ideas.

Peirce’s logic, conceived as semeiotic, characterizes a broad philosophical, methodological and scientific area of investigation. Although the present article has exposed a number of developments in Peirce’s studies in deductive logic, the deductive part is only a fraction of the wider project of semeiotic, the theory and philosophy of signs, and the logic of science. From a contemporary perspective, deductive, formal, and mathematical logic may have become the mainstay of logic as such, but for Peirce other areas of logic, such as speculative grammar and the critics and methodeutic of abduction and induction, are at least as important as the deductive part of logic.

3. Peirce’s Logic in Historical Perspective

Peirce’s algebraic work in formal logic influenced Ernst Schröder (1841–1902), who drew heavily upon Peirce’s work in the three volumes of his Vorlesungen über die Algebra der Logik (Schröder 1890–1905). Peirce also successfully initiated a school in logic during his Johns Hopkins period (1879–1884), whose most evident manifestation is the richness and originality of the papers contained in the Studies in Logic (Peirce 1883). For the main part of his career, Peirce had been in contact and correspondence with the most prominent logicians, mathematicians and scientists of the time, and his works appeared in leading scientific journals and proceedings.

All these facts notwithstanding, the reception of Peirce’s deductive logic has been strangely erratic, even in the early days. Especially in his later period (1892–1914), Peirce worked virtually alone in an adverse environment and without much intellectual and material support. It is true that the recognition of his contributions has suffered from a long-term unavailability of his vast Nachlass of over 100,000 surviving pages of manuscripts and correspondence. In some cases at least, the explanation may be found in the unprecedented technical and mathematical standard and rigor characterizing his work. But what is certainly a chief reason behind the general neglect of Peirce’s logic is the rise, at the end of the 19^th century, of what has later been named the Frege-Russell tradition in logic.

The historiography of logic seems to have accepted the idea, initially promoted by Bertrand Russell and subsequently canonized by historian of logic Jean van Heijenoort (1912–1986), of a “Fregean revolution” in logic. In this narrative, modern mathematical logic (also deceptively called symbolic logic) has replaced traditional or Aristotelian logic. According to such a picture, the work of the “algebraists,” (including Boole, De Morgan, Peirce and Schröder) belongs to the pre-Fregean logical paradigm.

Anellis (2012b) identified seven features of such a “Fregean” revolution: (1) A propositional calculus with a truth-functional definition of connectives, especially the conditional. (2) Decomposition of propositions into function and argument instead of into subject and predicate. (3) A quantification theory, based on a system of axioms and inference rules. (4) Definitions of infinite sequence and natural number in terms of logical notions (that is the logicization of mathematics). (5) Presentation and clarification of the concept of a formal system. (6) Relevance and use of logic for philosophical investigations (especially for philosophy of language). (7) Separating singular propositions, such as “Socrates is mortal” from universal propositions such as “All Greeks are mortal.” All these characteristics, Anellis argued, can be found in Peirce’s work, which therefore falls within the parameters of van Heijenoort’s conception of the Fregean revolution and the definition of mathematical logic. One also needs to remember that there are many characteristics of Peirce’s logic and philosophy of logic, vitally important to his logical vision, that either add to, modify or reject those that have been taken to typify the Fregean tradition. What may be ill-named as a Fregean revolution is found in a different, and perhaps more penetrating and consequential shape in Peirce’s work.

Peirce and Frege discovered quantificational theory around the same time (1879–1883). Frege’s work was at the time largely ignored. Russell credited Frege a posteriori with having founded modern logic in the Begriffsschrift (Frege 1879). However, while Frege’s notation was hardly ever used, the Peirce-Schröder notation was largely adopted by others. The important results of Löwenheim and Skolem at the beginning of the 20^th century were presented in the Peirce-Schröder system without any trace of influence by Frege or Russell. Peano’s use of the existential and universal quantifiers derives from Schröder and Peirce, not from Frege. Unlike Frege, Peirce recognized the utmost importance of dependent quantifiers and experimented with that idea in various ways in the algebra of logic and in existential graphs, and proposed new systems and dimensions of quantification that involve independent quantification (MS 430). Peirce’s overall influence upon the development of modern logic was considerable though its nature and scope had remained ill-understood for a long time (Putnam 1982; Dipert 1995; Pietarinen 2015a).

Peirce’s philosophy of logic had no better fate. Aside from Josiah Royce and especially Lady Victoria Welby with whom Peirce corresponded on the logic of signs and semiotics during 1903-1910, Peirce’s radical idea of “logic as semeiotic” largely passed by unnoticed. In the 1930s Charles Morris took, misleadingly, Peirce’s trivium of speculative grammar, critics and methodeutic to correspond to the division of the study of language into syntax, semantics, and pragmatics (Morris 1938, pp. 21-22). Carnap (1942) adopted Morris’ trichotomy and made it popular. Peirce’s philosophy of signs has since been studied by semioticians, led by the pioneering explorations by Roman Jakobson and Umberto Eco (see Eco 1975; Jakobson 1977; Eco 1984). Other aspects of Peirce’s philosophy of logic, such as the distinction between corollarial and theorematic deduction, his ideas on diagrammatic reasoning, and the evolution of new logical notations and meanings, is gaining the interest, not only of logicians and historians of logic, but also of philosophers of science, cognitive scientists as well as many scholars, scientists, artists and practitioners looking for ways to overcome boundaries of narrow conceptions of logic, reasoning and representation, as well as the outdated 20^th-century scientific methodologies that have characterized their respective fields. [See for example the 2014 Peirce Centennial Conference at Lowell as well as the Applying Peirce Conference series at Helsinki in 2007 and 2014, which have brought together scholars and scientists interested in Peirce’s thought virtually on any field of science.]

From the perspectives of the history and philosophy of modern logic, it may not be entirely right to talk in strict terms about the two traditions in logic, namely those of the algebraic and the symbolic ones. On the one hand, Peirce’s line of work in the algebra of logic led to the invention of a spectrum of methods in the semantic and model-theoretic tradition while the logic that Schröder, for example, preferred was to quantify over the entire universe and was thus at bottom a universalist one, thereby sharing the same preference as Frege. On the other hand, Peirce’s continuous search for new notations for the purposes of logical analysis and representation made what others may have considered to be the subject of symbolic notations really the subject of diagrams and icons. Algebraic notations were for Peirce iconic and often even very graphically so. What mattered to him was to remain clear of the significations of logical signs. Logical signs were to be interpreted in proper contexts and according to the purposes of investigation at hand. Thus, Peirce’s philosophy of logic stands in stark contrast to purely formal, mathematical and proof-theoretic approaches to logic, which do not care so much for signification. Peirce should accordingly be counted in the pragmatic, rather than just the semantic, tradition in philosophy of logic and language (Pietarinen 2006; Tiercelin 1991).

The famous van Heijenoort–Hintikka distinction between “logic as calculus” and “logic as a universal medium” is nonetheless instructive here (van Heijenoort 1967; Hintikka 1997; Peckhaus 2004). According to the former view of logic as calculus, methods and languages are many, they are reinterpretable according to the context and purposes at hand, and they admit of many and varying universes as well as modal and intensional considerations. The latter, universalist position means, in contrast, that there is one logic to “rule them all,” and so our thought is bounded by what that logic can express. Peirce fits squarely into the former camp. Here again it is not that all who worked on the algebra of logic would be members of that same camp (Schröder is a counterexample), or that all of those who in the literature have been tagged as formalists would share the universalist presuppositions (David Hilbert may serve as another kind of a counterexample). It may be one of the lessons of Peirce’s pragmaticism and the methodological pluralism which he exercised in his logic that one does not fix in advance what may in the future be considered to fall within the scope of logic.

4. References and Further Reading

• Peirce’s works
• 1867. An Improvement in Boole’s Calculus of Logic. Proceedings of the American Academy of Arts and Sciences 7, pp. 249-261.
• 1870. Description of a Notation for the Logic of Relatives. Memoirs of the American Academy of Arts and Sciences 9, pp. 317-378.
• 1880a. On the Algebra of Logic.  American Journal of Mathematics 3, pp. 15–57.
• 1881. On the Logic of Number. American Journal of Mathematics 4, pp. 85-95.
• 1883 (ed.). Studies in Logic by Members of the Johns Hopkins University. Boston: Little, Brown, and Co. 1883.
• 1885. On the Algebra of Logic. A Contribution to the Philosophy of Notation. American Journal of Mathematics 7, pp. 197–202.
• 1897. The Logic of Relatives. The Monist 7, pp. 161–217.
• 1901-1902. Entries in Dictionary of Philosophy and Psychology, 3 vols, edited by Baldwin, James Mark. Cited as DPP followed by volume and page number.
• 1906. Prolegomena to an Apology for Pragmaticism. The Monist 16, pp. 492–546.
• 1908. Some Amazing Mazes. The Monist 18 (3), pp. 416-464.
• 1931–1966. The Collected Papers of Charles S. Peirce, 8 vols., ed. by Hartshorne, C, Weiss, P. and Burks, A. W. Cambridge: Harvard University Press. Cited as CP followed by volume and paragraph number.
• 1967. Manuscripts in the Houghton Library of Harvard University, as identified by Richard Robin, “Annotated Catalogue of the Papers of Charles S. Peirce,” Amherst: University of Massachusetts Press, 1967, and in “The Peirce Papers: A supplementary catalogue,” Transactions of the C. S. Peirce Society 7 (1971): 37–57. Cited as MS followed by manuscript number and, when available, page number.
• 1976. The New Elements of Mathematics by Charles S. Peirce, 4 vols., ed. by Eisele, C. The Hague: Mouton. Cited as NEM followed by volume and page number.
• 1982 – …. Writings of Charles S. Peirce: A Chronological Edition, 7 vols., ed. by. Moore, E. C., Kloesel, C. J. W. et al. Bloomington: Indiana University Press. Cited as W followed by volume and page number.
• 2010. Philosophy of Mathematics: Selected Writings, ed. by M. E. Moore, Bloomington and Indianapolis, IN: Indiana University Press. Cited as PM.
• 2015. Logic of the Future. Peirce’s Writings on Existential Graphs, ed. by A.-V. Pietarinen, Bloomington: Indiana University Press. Cited as LoF.
• Other works
• Anellis, I. 2012a. Peirce’s Truth-Functional Analysis and the Origin of the Truth Table. History and Philosophy of Logic 33, pp. 37–41.
• Anellis, I. 2012b. How Peircean was the ‘Fregean’ Revolution in Logic? arXiv:1201.0353.
• Badesa, C. 2004. The Birth of Model Theory: Löwenheim’s Theorem in the Frame of the Theory of Relatives, Princeton: Princeton University Press.
• Bellucci, F. & Pietarinen, A.-V. (2014). New Light on Peirce’s Concept of Retroduction and Scientific Reasoning, International Studies in the Philosophy of Science 28(2), pp. 1-21.
• Bellucci, F. & Pietarinen, A.-V. (2015). Existential Graphs as an Instrument of Logical Analysis. Part I: Alpha, to appear.
• Bellucci, F., Pietarinen, A.-V. & Stjernfelt, F. eds. 2014. Peirce: 5 Questions. VIP/Automatic Press.
• Boole, G. 1847. The Mathematical Analysis of Logic. Cambridge: Macmillan, Barclay, & Macmillan.
• Boole, G. 1854. An Investigation of the Laws of Thought. Cambridge: Walton & Maberly.
• Brady, G. 2000. From Peirce to Skolem. Amsterdam: Elsevier Science.
• Brent, B. 1987. Charles S. Peirce. Logic and the Classification of the Sciences, Kingston/Montreal: MacGill-Queen’s University Press
• Burch, R. W. 2011. Peirce’s 10, 28, and 66 Sign-Types: The Simplest Mathematics. Semiotica 184, pp. 93–98.
• Burks, A. W. 1946. Peirce’s Theory of Abduction. Philosophy of Science 13, pp. 301-306.
• Carnap, R. 1942. Introduction to Semantics, Cambridge, Mass: MIT Press.
• Chauviré, Ch. 1994. Logique et Grammaire Pure. Propositions, Sujets et Prédicats Chez Peirce. Histoire Epistémologie Langage 16, pp. 137–175.
• Cheng, C.-Y. 1969. Peirce’s and Lewis’s Theories of Induction, The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff.
• Clark, G. 1997. New Light on Peirce’s Iconic Notation for the Sixteen Binary Connectives. In Houser and others 1997, pp. 304-333.
• Dedekind, R. 1888. Was sind und was sollen die Zahlen. Braunschweig: Vieweg.
• Dekker, Paul 2001. Dynamics and Pragmatics of ‘Peirce’s Puzzle’, Journal of Semantics 18, pp. 211-241.
• De Morgan, A. 1847. Formal Logic. London: Taylor and Walton.
• De Morgan, A. 1860. On the Syllogism IV; and on the Logic of Relations. Transactions of the Cambridge Philosophical Society 10, pp. 331-358.
• Dipert, R. 1995. Peirce’s Underestimated Place in the History of Logic: A Response to Quine. In Ketner, K. L. ed. Peirce and Contemporary Thought. New York: Fordham University Press, pp. 32-58.
• Dipert, R. 2006. Peirce’s Deductive Logic: Its Development, Influence, and Philosophical Significance. In: Misak, C. (ed.). The Cambridge Companion to Peirce. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, pp. 287-324.
• Eco, U. 1975. Trattato di semiotica generale. Milano: Bompiani.
• Eco, U. 1984. Semiotica e filosofia del linguaggio. Torino: Einaudi.
• Fann, K. T. 1970. Peirce’s Theory of Abduction. The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff.
• Ferriani, M. 1987. Peirce’s Analysis of the Proposition: Grammatical and Logical Aspects. In Ferriani, M. & Buzzetti, D. (eds.), Speculative grammar, universal grammar and philosophical analysis of language. Amsterdam: Benjamins, pp. 149-172.
• Fisch, M. H. 1982. The Range of Peirce’s Relevance, The Monist 65, pp. 123-141. Reprinted in Fisch 1986, pp. 422-448.
• Fisch, M. H. 1986. Peirce, Semeiotic and Pragmatism. Ed. by K. L. Ketner and C. J. W. Kloesel, Bloomington: Indiana University Press.
• Fisch, M. H. & Turquette, A. 1966. Peirce’s Triadic Logic. Transactions of the Charles S. Peirce Society 2, pp.71-85.
• Forster, P. 1989. Peirce on the Progress and Authority of Science. Transactions of the Charles S. Peirce Society 25, pp. 421–452.
• Frege, G. 1879. Begriffsschrift: eine der arithmetischen nachgebildete Formelsprache des reinen Denkens. Halle: Louis Nebert.
• Goudge, T. 1946. Peirce’s Treatment of Induction. Philosophy of Science 7, pp. 56-68.
• Haack, S. 1993. Peirce and Logicism: Notes Towards an Exposition. Transactions of the Charles S. Peirce Society 29, pp. 33–56.
• Havenel, J. 2010. Peirce’s Topological Concepts. In Moore 2010, pp. 283-322.
• Hilpinen, R. 1982. On C. S. Peirceʼs Theory of the Proposition: Peirce as a Precursor of Game-Theoretical Semantics. The Monist 65, pp. 182-188.
• Hilpinen, R. 1992. On Peirce’s Philosophical Logic: Propositions and Their Objects. Transactions of the Charles S. Peirce Society 28, pp. 467–488.
• Hilpinen, R. 2004. Peirce’s Logic, in Gabbay, D.M., and J. Woods. 2004. Handbook of the History of Logic. Vol. 3: The Rise of Modern Logic From Leibniz to Frege. Vol. 3. Amsterdam: Elsevier North-Holland, pp. 611-658.
• Hintikka, J. 1980. C. S. Peirce’s ‘First Real Discovery’ and Its Contemporary Relevance. Monist 63, pp. 304-315.
• Hintikka, J. 1996. The Place of C. S. Peirce in the History of Logical Theory. In J. Brunning, J. & Forster, P. eds. The Rule of Reason: The Philosophy of Charles Sanders Peirce, Toronto: University of Toronto Press, pp. 13–33.
• Hintikka, J. 1997. Lingua Universalis vs. Calculus Ratiocinator: An Ultimate Presupposition of Twentieth Century Philosophy. Dordrecht: Kluwer.
• Hintikka, J. 2011. What the bald man can tell us. In: Biletzky, A. (ed.) Hues of Philosophy: Essays in Memory of Ruth Manor. London: College Publications.
• Hoffmann, M. 2010. Theoric Transformations. Transactions of the Charles S. Peirce Society 46, pp. 570–590.
• Houser, N. 1993. On ‘Peirce and Logicism’: A Response to Haack. Transactions of the Charles S. Peirce Society 29, pp. 57–67.
• Houser, N., Roberts, D., Van Evra, J. eds. 1997. Studies in the Logic of Charles S. Peirce. Bloomington and Indianapolis: Indiana University Press.
• Jakobson, R. 1977. A Few Remarks on Peirce, Pathfinder in the Science of Language. MLN 92, pp. 1026–1032.
• Kapitan, T. 1992. Peirce and the Autonomy of Abductive Reasoning. Erkenntnis 37, pp. 1–26.
• Kapitan, T. 1997. Peirce and the Structure of Abductive Inference. In Houser and others eds. 1997, pp. 477-496.
• Kempe, A. B. 1886. A Memoir on the Theory of Mathematical Form. Philosophical Transactions of the Royal Society of London 177, pp. 1-70.
• Ketner, K. L. 1985. How Hintikka Misunderstood Peirce’s Account of Theorematic Reasoning. Transactions of the Charles S. Peirce Society 21, pp. 407–418.
• Lane, R. 1999. Peirce’s Triadic Logic Revisited. Transactions of the Charles S. Peirce Society 35, pp. 284–311.
• Lewis, C. I. 1918.  A Survey of Symbolic Logic. Berkeley: University of California Press.
• Lupher, T. and Adajian, T. eds. 2015. Philosophy of Logic: 5 Questions. Copenhagen: Automatic Press.
• Ma, Minghui & Pietarinen, A.-V. 2015. A dynamic approach to Peirce’s interrogative construal of abductive reasoning, IFCoLog Journal of Logics and their Applications, in press.
• Mannoury, G. 1909. Methodologisches und Philosophisches zur Elementar-Mathematik. Haarlem: P. Visser.
• Merrill, D. D. 1997. Relations and Quantification in Peirce’s Logic, 1870-1885. In Houser et. al. eds. 1997, pp. 158-172.
• Merrill, G. H. 1975. Peirce on Probability and Induction. Transactions of the Charles S. Peirce Society 11, pp. 90–109.
• Moore, M. ed. 2010. New Essays on Peirce’s Mathematical Philosophy. Chicago: Open Court.
• Morris, C.  W. 1938. Foundations of the Theory of Signs. In Morris, C. 1971. Writings on the General Theory of Signs. The Hague: Mouton.
• Murphey, M. G. 1961. The Development of Peirce’s Philosophy, Cambridge, Mass: Harvard University Press, 2^nd ed. 1993, Indianapolis: Hackett.
• Paavola, S. 2004. Abduction as a Logic and Methodology of Discovery: The Importance of Strategies. Foundations of Science 9, pp. 267–283.
• Peano, G. 1889. Arithmetices Principia. Nova Methodo Exposita. Torino: Bocca.
• Peckhaus, V. 2004. Calculus Ratiocinator vs. Characteristica Universalis? The Two Traditions in Logic, Revisited. History and Philosophy of Logic 25, pp. 3-14.
• Peirce, B. 1870. Linear Associative Algebra. Litographated ed., Washington D.C.
• Pietarinen, A.-V. 2005. Compositionality, Relevance and Peirce’s Logic of Existential Graphs. Axiomathes 15, pp. 513-540.
• Pietarinen, A.-V. 2006. Signs of Logic: Peircean Themes on the Philosophy of Language, Games and Communication. Dordrecht: Springer.
• Pietarinen, A.-V. 2011. Existential Graphs: What a Diagrammatic Logic of Cognition Might Look Like. History and Philosophy of Logic 32, pp. 265–281.
• Pietarinen, A.-V. 2013. Logical and Linguistic Games from Peirce to Grice to Hintikka (with comments by J. Hintikka). Teorema 33, pp. 121-136.
• Pietarinen, A.-V. 2015a. Exploring the Beta Quadrant. Synthese 192, pp. 941-970.
• Pietarinen, A.-V. ed. 2015b. Two Papers on Existential Graphs by Charles S. Peirce: 1. Recent Developments of Existential Graphs and their Consequences for Logic (MS 498, 499, 490, S-36, 1906), 2. Assurance through Reasoning (MS 669, 670, 1911). Synthese 192, pp. 881-922.
• Pietarinen, A.-V. & Bellucci, F. 2015a. Habits of Reasoning: On the Grammar and Critics of Logical Habits. In D. E. West & M. Anderson eds. Consensus on Peirce’s Concept of Habit: Before and Beyond Consciousness. Dordrecht: Springer.
• Pietarinen, A.-V. & Bellucci, F. 2015b. The Iconic Moment: Towards a Peircean Theory of Diagrammatic Imagination. In J. Redmond, A. N. Fernàndez, O. Pombo eds. Epistemology, Knowledge, and the Impact of Interaction, Dordrecht: Springer.
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Author Information

Francesco Bellucci
Email: bellucci.francesco@gmail.com
Tallinn University of Technology
Estonia

and

Ahti-Veikko Pietarinen
Email: ahti-veikko.pietarinen@ttu.ee
Tallinn University of Technology
Estonia

Adolf Lindenbaum (1904-1941)

Adolf Lindenbaum was a Polish mathematician and logician who worked in topology, set theory, metalogic, general metamathematics and the foundations of mathematics. He represented an attitude typical of the Polish Mathematical School, consisting of using all admissible methods, independently of whether they were finitary. For example, the axiom of choice was freely applied, but on the other hand, proofs omitting this axiom were welcomed. In set theory, Lindenbaum and Tarski posed an important conjecture that the generalized continuum hypothesis entails the axiom of choice. Among the most important metalogical and metamathematical results obtained by Lindenbaum are the following: every system of propositional calculus has an at most denumerably infinite normal matrix; the construction of the so–called Lindenbaum algebra; and the maximalization theorem.

Lindenbaum studied mathematics under Wacław Sierpiński, Stefan Mazurkiewicz and Kazimierz Kuratowski in Warsaw. As part of the Lvov–Warsaw School, formed by a powerful Polish group of analytic philosophers, Lindenbaum belonged to the Polish mathematical school and the Warsaw school of logic. He began his career as a topologist, and his doctoral dissertation, written under Sierpiński, was devoted to properties of point–sets. Then in the mid–1920s he switched to logic and joined the Warsaw School of Logic that was established by Jan Łukasiewicz and Stanisław Leśniewski after World War I. Lindenbaum was a close friend and collaborator of Alfred Tarski.

Table of Contents

1. Biography
2. A General Outline of Lindenbaum’s Scientific Career and His Views
3. Lindenbaum and Set Theory
4. Lindenbaum and Logical Calculi
5. Lindenbaum and General Metamathematics
6. Final Remarks
7. References and Further Reading

1. Biography

Adolf Lindenbaum was born in an assimilated (that is, polonized) rich Jewish family in Warsaw on June 12, 1904. He took his secondary education at M. Kreczmar’s Gymnasium in Warsaw from 1915 to 1922, and then he entered Warsaw University to study mathematics from 1922 to 1926. There his teachers included Kazimierz Kuratowski, Stefan Mazurkiewicz and Wacław Sierpiński in mathematics as well as Stanisław Leśniewski and Jan Łukasiewicz in logic. Lindenbaum also attended Alfred Tarski’s courses on cardinal numbers and elementary mathematics, Tadeusz Kotarbiński’s course in logic, and some classes in humanities. The latter included history of philosophy, Władysław Tatarkiewicz’s special class on Kant, Tatarkiewicz’s course on French art, a course in psychology by Władysław Witwicki, a course on linguistics by Karol Appel, a course on literature by Józef Ujejski, including his course on Adama Mickiewicz, the most important Polish national poet, and a course on the history and culture of Palestine by Moses Schorr.

Sierpiński supervised Lindenbaum’s Ph.D. dissertation entitled O Własnościach Mnogości Punktowych (On Properties of Point–Sets). The thesis was defended in 1928, and Lindenbaum received the title of Doctor of Philosophy. In 1934 he presented his Habilitation thesis, based on several published papers, to the Faculty of Mathematics and Natural Sciences at Warsaw University and obtained the degree of Docent (a person who could lecture). This resulted in his appointment as adjunct professor at the Philosophical Seminar at the same faculty. The Philosophical Seminar was an independent unit at the Faculty of Mathematics and Science directed for years by Łukasiewicz. It was the Logical Seminar. Lindenbaum lectured on various mathematical and logical topics from 1935 to 1939. His courses, for example, concerned the following topics: “On New Investigations into the Foundations of Mathematics and the Mathematical Foundations of other Disciplines”, “On Superposition of Functions” and “Selected Topics from Metrology and from the Theory of Functions”. He stood little chance of being promoted to an academic position higher than docent because of the anti–Semitic policy in Polish universities after 1935,  and his involvement in the communist movement, as well as the shortage of university positions at the time. He was also a tutor at the Scientific Circle of Jewish Students at Warsaw University, established after the exclusion (in the 1890s) of the Jews from general students’ associations existing in Poland.

Lindenbaum was a typical, good–looking bon vivant. He married a beautiful Jewish woman, Janina Hosiasson, who also was a logician and who successfully worked on induction and confirmation. She and Adolf became separated at the beginning of World War II (as Janina Hosiasson informed Alfred Tarski in one of her letters in early 1941, a letter that is in the Tarski Archive in U.C. Berkeley’s Bancroft Library).

Lindenbaum was a declared leftist. He belonged to the Polish Communist Party (KPP) until its dissolution by Stalin in 1938; He also was an activist in the intelligentsia circles. In 1936 Lindenbaum signed a petition demanding that Carl von Ossietzky, a journalist imprisoned by the Nazis, be awarded the Nobel Peace Prize, and he protested against the massacre of workers in Lvov in 1936. Mrs. Janina Kotarbiński, the wife of Tadeusz Kotarbiński who was a close friend of the Lindenbaums reported the following story:

It happened that I and Antoni Pański [also a philosopher – J. W] visited the Lindenbaums in their apartment. I noticed on Dolek’s [the diminutive of Adolf – J. W.] desk the Short Philosophical Dictionary [the dictionary written by Pavel Yudin and Mark Rozental and published in Russian in the Soviet Union at the beginning of the 1930s. The authors represented the Stalinist version of Marxism. The Short Philosophical Dictionary became a symbol of the orthodox Marxist ideology – J. W.]. The book was opened at the entry ‘Dialectical Contradiction’. I was surprised, and on our way back I asked Pański why Dolek, such a clever person, read such stupidities about the concept of contradiction. Pański answered that Dolek believed in every word of this book.

She added, however, that Lindenbaum had a considerable interest in philosophy without any kind of dogmatism. He was ready for an open discussion on any philosophical issue. Lindenbaum was strongly interested in literature and art, and was famous as a passionate climber.

After the outbreak of World War II, Lindenbaum immediately realized that for his own security he should escape before the German army would take Warsaw. His Jewish origin was probably not the only reason behind this decision. More importantly, it was obvious that the Germans possessed the lists of Polish communists and other critics of Hitler’s regime. Lindenbaum was particularly afraid of the consequences of the support he had given to Ossietzky, because such actions were strongly, even furiously, criticized in Germany. Although Lindenbaum could emigrate to the West or get a position in Moscow as a scientist, he decided to remain in Poland, because he had hope in the socialist future of the country. The Lindenbaums left Warsaw on September 6, 1939 and went to Vilna (presently Vilnius); this city, formerly in Poland, became the capital of Lithuania after September 17, 1939. Lithuania was an independent country in 1918–1939 with Kaunas as its capital; in 1939–1941 Lithuania was formally independent, but entirely dependent on the Soviet Union. It was occupied by Germany after its attack on the Soviet Union on June 22, 1941. Janina remained there, but Adolf moved to Bialystok, a city occupied by the Soviet Army after its invasion into Poland on September 17; he probably expected this part of Poland to become the center of the future Polish communist state. Lindenbaum was appointed as a docent in the Bialystok Pedagogical Institute established by the Soviet authorities, and he taught mathematics there. The German–Soviet War started on June 22, 1941, and the Germans soon came to Bialystok. The reasons why Lindenbaum did not leave the city are unknown. In September 1941, he was arrested by the Gestapo, transported to Vilnius, and killed in Ponary (the place of many massacres, particularly of the Jews in 1941–1944) near the Lithuanian capital. Janina Hossiasson–Lindenbaum was murdered in Vilnius in 1942. The more exact dates of the deaths of the Lindenbaums remain unknown.

See (Mostowski–Marczewski 1971), (Surma 1982), (Zygmunt–Purdy 2014) for more biographical data on Lindenbaum).

2. A General Outline of Lindenbaum’s Scientific Career and His Views

Lindenbaum began his scientific carrier as a topologist, but he soon converted to logic and the foundations of mathematics. He and Tarski (three years older) became friends in the early 1920s, and the latter influenced Lindenbaum in the direction of mathematical logic and the foundations of mathematics. Both shared not only scientific interests, but also a negative attitude to any version of religion, various leftist political ideas and a love of mountains and literature, but they were also very sensitive to their fate as secular Jews and their pretending to be assimilated and accepted by Polish society. Neither of them, however, was successful in the last respect. At the beginning of his scientific career, he was very active in the Student Mathematical Scientific Circle as well as in the Student Philosophical Circle, and he successfully promoted logic among his colleagues in both groups. In particular, he delivered several lectures on logical problems at the meetings of both circles. He was a mentor in logic to students in Warsaw. For instance, he wrote a section on logic in the Mathematical-Physical Study: Information Book for Newcomers published in 1926 in which he reported how logic was taught in Warsaw. It is a very interesting document which shows how powerful logic was in Warsaw in the mid–1920s. The revelation that the Principia Mathematica was recommended as a textbook for advanced students seems really shocking. Lindenbaum’s brilliant personality, charming style of life and powerful mathematical skills fascinated the Warsaw scientific community. Not surprisingly, he was commonly considered one of the most gifted Polish mathematicians of his generation. Tarski 1949, p. XII described Lindenbaum as “a man of unusual intelligence”. Mostowski once called Lindenbaum the most lucid mind in the foundations of mathematics. Legendary stories told by Lindenbaum’s friends and colleagues document many cases of theorems discovered by him but proved by someone else, as he had no time to complete his ideas. Yet the list of his scientific contributions is quite long; it comprises more than 40 papers, abstracts and reviews (see Surma 1982 for Lindenbaum’s bibliography), mostly published in German and French. Some of Lindenbaum’s papers were co–authored, in particular, by Tarski and Andrzej Mostowski. Lindenbaum and Tarski worked on the book Theorie der Eindeutigen Abbildungen. It was announced as volume 8 of the series “Mathematical Monograph” to be published in 1938. This information is given on the back cover of S. Sachs, The Theory of Integral, Monografie Matematyczne, Warszawa–Lwów 1937 (co–published by G. E. Stechert, New York). Sachs’ book appeared as volume 7 of this series. This suggests that the book by Lindenbaum and Tarski was near to being completed. Lindenbaum was also well–perceived on the international scale. Leading logicians and mathematicians, including Wilhelm Ackermann, Friedrich Bachmann, Abraham Fraenkel, Andrei Kolmogoroff and Arnold Schmidt, reviewed his writings.  Lindenbaum actively participated in the Polish Mathematical Congresses and in the International Congress of Scientific Philosophy held in Paris in 1935.

Lindenbaum belonged to three scientific schools. One affiliation was with the Polish Mathematical School with Sierpiński, Mazurkiewicz and Kuratowski as its leaders in Warsaw. The second affiliation was the Warsaw School of Logic (Łukasiewicz, Leśniewski, Tarski—the latter joined the top of the School in the 1920s; see Woleński 1995 for a general presentation of logic in Poland in the interwar period). The third affiliation was with the Lvov–Warsaw School (Kazimierz Twardowski and his disciples from Lvov, in particular, Łukasiewicz, Leśniewski and Kotarbiński).

The second affiliation is perhaps the most important. The Warsaw School of Logic was a “child” of mathematicians and philosophers. Łukasiewicz and Leśniewski, the main figures in this group were philosophers by training. Nevertheless, they became professors at the Faculty of Mathematics and Natural Science at Warsaw University and were active in the mathematical environment. Zygmunt Janiszewski, another founding father of the Polish Mathematical School, who died prematurely before Lindenbaum entered the university, developed the so–called Janiszewski program, a very ambitious plan of the development of mathematics in Poland that attributed crucial significance to logic and the foundations on mathematics. The Fundamenta Mathematicae, a journal established by Janiszewski and serving from its inception as an official scientific journal of the Polish Mathematical School, published many papers by logicians. It is noteworthy that Mazurkiewicz, Sierpiński, Leśniewski, and Łukasiewicz—two professional mathematicians and two logicians originating from philosophy—formed the Editorial Board of the Fundamenta. It was important for the subsequent stormy development of logic in Warsaw that the mathematical milieu accepted philosophers as professional teachers of students of mathematics.

This double heritage, philosophical as well as mathematical, determined the scientific ideology of Warsaw logicians. Perhaps one point should be mentioned here as particularly important in this context. Firstly, the Polish Mathematical School did not assume any specific philosophical standpoint concerning the nature of mathematics. Methodologically speaking, all fruitful mathematical methods, particularly coming from set theory, could be used in logical investigations, provided that they did not lead to contradictions. The last statement should be understood in the following way. Clearly, proofs of consistency are important and required, however even before Gödel’s second incompleteness theorem (roughly speaking, that the consistency of arithmetic cannot be proved in arithmetic itself) was announced, Polish mathematicians maintained that if it is empirically known that a theory of given concepts is contradiction–free, it can be faithfully used in mathematical investigations including logical research. As a consequence, the Polish Mathematics School did not subscribe to logicism, formalism or intuitionism, which were the main foundational currents in the philosophy of mathematics, even though they were widely regarded as such in 1900–1930. On the other hand, Polish logicians worked on many problems suggested by Russell, Hilbert and Brouwer, the main exponents of the mentioned schools. Moreover, sometimes a tension held between private, so to speak, philosophical views of some Polish logicians and their research practices. For instance, Tarski, influenced by Leśniewski’s and Kotarbiński’s nominalism, expressed explicit sympathy with this view, but on the other hand, he did not hesitate to use higher set theory and inaccessible cardinals in the foundations of mathematics.

There is practically nothing known about Lindenbaum’s philosophical views concerning mathematics. Clearly, his inclinations to dialectical materialism had no influence on his philosophy of mathematics and foundational views. In fact, he shared the general attitude of the Polish Mathematical School mentioned above. Lindenbaum published some papers directly related to general foundational problems (for example, Lindenbaum 1930, Lindenbaum 1931) in which he recommended the use of mathematics in logical investigations without any hesitation with respect to employing infinitary methods. He pointed out that such methods were present even in elementary arithmetic. For instance, he published reviews of works by Polish radical nominalists, such as Leon Chwistek and Władysław Hetper, but he entirely abstained from philosophical comments. Two papers—Lindenbaum 1936 and Lindenbaum–Tarski 1934–1935—should be particularly mentioned. The former paper is Lindenbaum’s contribution to the Paris Congress in 1935. It concerns the formal simplicity of concepts. Although Lindenbaum points out that this question arises in many fields, he does not offer any general definition of simplicity. Lindenbaum distinguishes seven relevant problems concerning simplicity (a) of systems of concepts (terms); (b) of propositions and their systems; (c) of inference rules; (d) of proofs; (e) of definitions and constructions; (f) of deductive theories; (g) of formal languages; but he addresses his further considerations to (a). The idea is that measuring the number of letters occurring in a given concept can tell us about the simplicity of the term. Lindenbaum follows Leśniewski in this respect. Two points are interesting. First, Lindenbaum assumes the simple theory of types.  This suggests that he preferred a more elementary construction if it is possible and adequate for a given problem. This attitude was also very popular among Warsaw mathematicians and logicians. Second, Lindenbaum observes, obviously under Tarski’s influence, that simplicity has not only a syntactic dimension (in Carnap’s sense), but it should also be considered semantically.

The paper Lindenbaum–Tarski 1934–1935 basically concerns some metamathematical problems about the limitations of means of expressions (expressive power, to use present terminology) in deductive theories. The authors claim that all relations between objects (individuals, classes, relations, and so forth) expressible by purely logical means remain invariant under an arbitrary one–one mapping of the “world” (that is, the collection of all individuals) onto itself. Moreover, this invariance is logically provable. This idea was more fully developed by Tarski in his paper on logical concepts (see Tarski 1986). In a sense, the understanding of logical concepts as invariant under all one–one mappings has affinities with the Erlangen Program (Tarski stressed this point) in the foundations of geometry formulated by Felix Klein. Lindenbaum and Tarski proved a general theorem justifying the intuitive explanation of understanding logical relations as invariant under one–one mappings. The consequences of this approach to logical concepts for philosophy of logic are far–reaching. In particular, the Lindenbaum–Tarski definition of logical concepts motivates the theorem that logic does not distinguish any extralogical concept (roughly speaking, what can be proved in logic about an extralogical item, for instance, an individual, can be proved about any other individual). Consequently, logical theorems are true in all possible worlds (models). Thus, the definition in question naturally leads to seeing logic as invariant with respect to any specific content.

Lindenbaum’s works that are related to logic and the foundations of mathematics concern set theory and logical calculi, including their metalogical properties. This article deals with general set theory in section 3, while sections 4 and 5 are devoted to logical matters Section 3 skips special topics, including those belonging to other mathematical fields; the borderline between general and special set theory is somehow arbitrary; also some of Lindenbaum’s results are mentioned without entering into formal details.

Lindenbaum’s results in set theory were achieved in an individual collaboration with other authors, particularly Tarski and Mostowski. In the 1920s and 1930s Łukasiewicz conducted a seminar in mathematical logic. Its participants were the group of young logicians including, in addition to Lindenbaum and Tarski, Stanisław Jaśkowski, Andrzej Mostowski, Jerzy Słupecki, Bolesław Sobociński and Mordechaj Wajsberg. This seminar soon became a factory of new results in mathematical logic. Its participants collaboratively worked on problems. Lindenbaum’s results about logical calculi, as Łukasiewicz explicitly says, were achieved at this seminar. Lindenbaum frequently stated theorems, usually without proofs. His most important results were mentioned by others; some of them are to be found in Łukasiewicz–Tarski 1930 (refered to in this article as Ł–T1930).

3. Lindenbaum and Set Theory

In 1926, Lindenbaum and Tarski published the joint paper “Communication sur les Recherches de la Théorie de Ensembles” (Lindenbaum–Tarski 1926; the abbreviation L–T1926 is used in further references). This paper is very compact. In 30 pages the authors announced many results in set theory and its applications, that were achieved by them within the “last few years.” More particularly, theorems and definitions concerned cardinal and ordinal numbers, the relations between them and the theory of one–one mappings. The results were stated without proofs. The authors noted that proofs and further developments would appear in the subsequent writings. (Perhaps the already mentioned monograph Theorie der Eindeutigen Abbildungen was intended as a continuation of L–T1926; several related results are contained in Tarski 1949; Lindenbaum is mentioned in the Preface to this book as a person particularly effective in conducting research on cardinal numbers.) The spirit of the Polish Mathematical School is evident in this paper. The purely mathematical text is interrupted by historical and methodological comments; Polish mathematicians considered (and they still do) such remarks as a very important feature of mathematical prose. Due to the role of the axiom of choice (AC) in set theory and its controversial nature, results obtained without use of this axiom are grouped in a section different from the sections containing the theorems based on AC. The paper lists 102 theorems or lemmas about cardinal numbers, 5 theorems or lemmas about properties of one–one mappings, 16 theorems or lemmas about order types, 4 theorems on the arithmetic of ordinal numbers, and 19 theorems or lemmas on point–sets. In many cases, the investigations by Lindenbaum and Tarski continue the earlier works and achievements by Cantor, Dedekind, Bernstein, Fraenkel, Hartogs, Korselt, König, Lebesgue, von Neumann, Russell and Whitehead, Schröder, Zermelo, Banach, Kuratowski, Leśniewski and Sierpiński. In a sense, L–T1926 can serve as a very important historical report on the state of the art in set theory and its foundational problems in the mid–1920s.

Perhaps the most important result (theorem 94) announced in L–T1926 concerns the generalized continuum hypothesis (GCH) and AC. Lindenbaum posed the problem of how AC (one of the main focuses of Polish Mathematical School) is related to Cantor’s hypothesis on alephs (the name of GCH used in L–T1926). Theorem 94 states that GCH entails AC. This result was proved by Sierpiński in 1947 (see Sierpiński 1965, pp. 43–44, Moore 1982, pp. 215–217 for a brief survey). The search for equivalents of AC became one of the Polish mathematical specialties de la maison. Lindenbaum (L–T1926, theorem 82(L)) claimed that AC is equivalent to the assertion that for arbitrary cardinal numbers m and n, m ≤* n or n ≤* m (the symbol ≤* expresses the relation between cardinal numbers m and n such that either m = 0 or every set of power n is the sum of m mutually disjoint non–empty sets). This theorem was finally proved by Sierpiński in 1949 (see Sierpiński 1965, p. 435–436).  L–T1926 also presents the material on the Cantor–Bernstein theorem (CBT; Lindenbaum and Tarski used the label “the Schröder–Bernstein theorem”), which says that for any cardinal numbers m, n, if m ≤ n and n ≤ m, then m = n (see Hinkis 2013 for a very detailed historical exposition). In particular, Lindenbaum proposed some equivalents of CBT also in the terms of order–types of one–one mappings. One of the equivalents of CBT is the following proposition: for any order–types α, β, γ, δ, if α = β + γ and γ = α + δ, then α = γ (via one–one mappings: if an well-ordered set X is similar to a segment of an ordered set B, and B is similar to a residue of A, then both sets A and B are similar). Another interesting result related to the Bernstein Division Theorem (BDT) says that for any natural number k and any cardinal numbers m, n, if km = kn, then m = n. L–T1926 claims that Lindenbaum proved BDT in its full generality and made that without AC. Yet there is a slight historical controversy concerning the scope of Bernstein’s original proof (see Hinkis, p. 139). [A ⇔ B]? Leaving this question aside, there is no doubt that L–T1926 played an important role in the development of the foundations of set theory.

Finally, consider the paper by Lindenbaum and Mostowski (Lindenbaum–Mostowski 1938) on the independence of AC from other axioms of Zermelo–Fraenkel set theory (ZF). Abraham Fraenkel claimed that he proved the independence of AC (in its standard version postulating the existence of a choice set for any family of non–empty and disjoint sets) and its two equivalents (every set can be ordered; if for every family of finite and mutually disjoint sets, a choice set exists, then there exists a choice set for every countable family of sets with mutually disjoint set as elements) from ZF. Lindenbaum and Mostowski remark that Fraenkel’s investigations, though of great value, cannot be regarded as fully successful “because a dangerous confusion of metamathematical and mathematical notions is inherent in it”. More specifically, Fraenkel’s notions of model and function are obscure. Lindenbaum and Mostowski propose to understand the concept of function in a semantic manner, that is, as determined by the formula “a set satisfies a propositional function”.  Moreover, they point out an error in Fraenkel’s proof consisting in his treatment of permutations. Lindenbaum and Mostowski propose a modification of Fraenkel’s construction in order to correct his proof. It is done by the improving axiomatization with respect to axioms of separation, replacement and infinity. This step allows for proving that also other equivalents of AC are not derivable in ZF. The authors observe that ZF remains (relatively) consistent if we add the axiom “there exists an infinite set having not–sets as elements”. Moreover, the results cannot be obtained in the system in which sets are admitted as the only elements. These results were later completed by Mostowski. The models of the improved ZF with Urelements (items not being sets) are called the Fraenkel–Mostowski models. Perhaps a particularly interesting feature of Lindenbaum–Mostowski 1938 consists in the conscious use of semantic methods in the metamathematics of set theory.

4. Lindenbaum and Logical Calculi

This section reviews Lindenbaum’s results in metalogic of propositional calculus.  They were announced at Łukasiewicz’s seminar in mathematical logic in 1926–1930. Łukasiewicz initiated a research program devoted to propositional (sentential) logic, classical as well as many–valued (the results are collected in Ł–T1930). The two main directions of investigations were executed by Łukasiewicz’s group. First, constructions of sentential logic as axiomatic systems were undertaken. Łukasiewicz and his students looked for independent and possibly economic axioms (economic in the sense of having the minimal number of axioms consisting of the shortest number of symbols). Second, Warsaw logicians—mostly Tarski—invented and systematized the basic metalogical tools for investigations of propositional calculus. Lindenbaum, contrary to the majority of the members of  Łukasiewicz seminar, had no interest in proposing new axiomatizations of logic. His activities belonged entirely to metalogic. More specifically, Lindenbaum contributed to the matrix method, that is, to investigating sentential logic via logical matrices. They are generalizations of the well–known truth–tables.

Abstractly speaking, (note that the level of abstraction is higher in Ł–T1930), a logical matrix is an ordered quadruple M = [U, U’, f, g] such that U and U’ are two arbitrary sets (in order to exclude trivial cases, both sets are assumed to be non–empty), U has at least two elements, U’ ⊂ U, f is a binary function, and g is a unary function. Both functions are defined for U and take values from U. The intended interpretation is as follows: U – the set of logical values, U’ ­– the set of designated logical values. In the case of two–valued logic (1 – truth, 0 – falsehood), U’ = {1, 0} and U’ = {0}. Assume that L is a language of sentential logic. If A ∈ L, then f(A), g(A) ∈ U. Intuitively speaking, f and g are valuation functions defined for formulas of L taking values from U; if language is not taken into account, M is an algebra of (logical or other) values.  Write v(A) for “v is a logical value of A in M”. The matrix M is normal provided that if v(A) ∈ U’ and v(B) ∈ U, then v(A, B) ∈ U. Roughly speaking, values of compound formulas always belong to U, independently of whether their constituents are valued by designated values or other (undesignated) values.  If A ∈ L and for every w, w(A) = 1, then A is a tautology in M (A is verified by M). We can consider g as the function corresponding to negation and f as the counterpart of implication. Thus, v(¬A) = 1, if v(A) = 0, v(¬A) = 0, if v(A) = 1; v(A ⇒ B) = 1, if v(A) = 0 or v(B) = 1, otherwise v(A ⇒ B) = 1. These equalities show that truth–tables for implication and negation are special cases of logical matrices in the abstract sense.

Lindenbaum established several important theorems connecting propositional calculi with logical matrices (they are listed in a different order than the theorems appear in Ł–T 1930; this paper contains no proofs). Let the symbol LOG_ℵ0 refer to a many–valued logic with a denumerably infinite set of logical values. Łukasiewicz defined matrices for such a system. Lindenbaum (theorem 16 in Ł–T 1930) established that LOG_ℵ0 can be characterized by a matrix in which U’ = {1}, functions f and g satisfy the conditions f(x, y) = min(1, 1 – x + y),  g(x) = 1 – x and U is an arbitrary infinite set of numbers which satisfies the condition 0 < x < 1 for any element of U and is closed under the operations f and g. Lindenbaum also proved (theorem 19 in Ł–T 1930) the following logico–arithmetical result (the converse of a result obtained earlier by Łukasiewicz): for 2 ≤ m ≤ ℵ₀ and 2 ≤ n ≤ ℵ₀, we have the equivalence LOG_m ⊆ LOG_n if and only if n – 1 is a divisor of m – 1. The next theorem established by Lindenbaum for n = 3 (Tarski generalized this result for any prime number) says if n is a prime number that there are only two systems L (the entire language) and LOG₂ which contain LOG₃ as a proper part. Lindenbaum also proved (Ł–T1930, theorem 23) that every logic LOG_n is axiomatizable for any 1 ≤ n < ℵ₀.

Although the above results are general, they were mainly directed as reporting facts on many–valued logic. Lindenbaum also obtained the results on arbitrary sentential calculi and their matrices. The definition of M (plus the definition of a sentential calculus as closed by the consequence operation) implies that the set of tautologies in a matrix, that is, LOG(M), provided that M is normal, is a system. Lindenbaum announced (theorem 3 in Ł–T 1930) that every sentential calculus has at most a denumerably infinite normal matrix. This theorem was proved by Jerzy Łoś (see Łoś 1949; this work contains the first systematic treatment of logical matrices). This last work originated from systematic investigations on matrix semantics for propositional calculi (see Wójcicki 1989 for an extensive report on this field of logical research; several important results are also described in Pogorzelski 1994). The following historical speculation can illustrate the importance of theorem 3. When Heyting formalized intuitionistic sentential logic (ISC) in 1930, the question of finding a normal matrix for this logic became important. Gödel showed (in 1932) that no finite matrix (he used the term “realization”) verifies all theorems of ISC. By Lindenbaum’s result (Gödel did not refer to it), there exists a denumerably infinite normal matrix ISC. Jaśkowski constructed it in 1936. He certainly must have known Ł–T 1930, but he did not refer to it. This story makes a nice example of how influences could interplay in looking for an adequate matrix for intuitionistic propositional logic; but we have no accessible evidence that Lindenbaum’s theorem actually inspired Jaśkowski.

5. Lindenbaum and General Metamathematics

Several of Lindenbaum’s contributions to general metamathematics are mentioned in Tarski 1956 (referred to as T1956 below). The two most important results achieved by Lindenbaum are his construction of the so–called Lindenbaum algebra (LIA) and the maximalization theorem LMT (frequently called the Lindenbaum Lemma). Lindenbaum observed that formulas can be the elements of logical matrices (see Surma 1967, Surma 1973, Surma 1982 for the reconstruction of Lindenbaum’s path to LIA). Then, he as well as other logicians (Łoś, for instance) generalized this idea for arbitrary languages. LIA is presented in this article for classical sentential calculus. Let L be a formal language with ¬, ∧, ∨, ⇒, ⇔ as connectives. Formulas as such, that is, variables and their well–formed strings do not constitute an algebra. The symbol [A] refers to the Lindenbaum class of formulas with respect to A. We further stipulate that B ∈ [A] if and only if ├ A ⇔ B (this step gives a congruence in L) and then define –[A] as [¬A], [A] ∩ [B]  as [A ∧ B], [A] ∪ [B]  as [A ∨ B], [A] ⊆ [B] as [A ⇒ B], and [A ⇔  B] as [A] = [B]. If we denote the set of classes of formulas produced by the defined congruence by the symbol L_[≈],  the structure < L_[≈], –, ∩, ∪, ⊆ , = > is a Boolean algebra of formulas, that is, LIA for sentential logic. An interesting feature of this construction is that building blocks for LIA come from language. This justifies the use of the same symbols for propositional connectives in the object language (the language of propositional calculus) and the metalanguage, (the language of LIA). Lindenbaum’s construction of algebras has important applications in algebraic proofs of metalogical theorems (see Surma 1967, Rasiowa–Sikorski 1970, Surma 1973, Rasiowa 1974, Surma 1982, Zygmunt–Pardy 2014), including the completeness theorem for classical logic as well as many non–classical systems.

There is a controversy concerning the origin of LIA. According to Surma 1967, p. 128 Lindenbaum presented his idea at the 1^st Polish Mathematical Congress in 1927. This fact, however, is only known from the Polish oral tradition. Significant information can be found in Rasiowa,–Sikorski 1970, 245–246, footnote 1. The first published mention was made by McKinsey with reference to Tarski’s oral communication in 1941. However, Tarski complained that the discovery of LIA should be credited to him (it is reported in the mentioned footnote in Rasiowa–Sikorski 1974).  Since Tarski’s historical claim concerning LIA is known, some authors used label “the Lindenbaum–Tarski algebra”.

MT is perhaps the most important result achieved by Lindenbaum. Its formulation is very simple: every consistent formal system has its maximal and consistent extension. The theorem was probably inspired by the concept of Post–completeness, well known in the Łukasiewicz’s group. This theorem is mentioned several times in T1956; its proof is to be found on pp. 98–100. An important feature of LMT consists in the fact that it is not intuitionistically  provable (although we know that maximal extensions exist, there is no general method of their construction) and it requires infinitistic methods (it is but weaker than AC; see below). T1956 points out many applications of LMT, for instance, that classical logic is the only consistent extension of intuitionistic logic (Tarski). The great career of LMT began after Henkin had used it in his proof of the completeness of first–order logic. This proof combines together LIA and the construction of maximal consistent sets of formulas. Henkin’s method became adapted for proving the completeness property of many logical systems. LMT is effectively equivalent to the Stone ultrafilter theorem. One can prove (see Surma  1968) that AC implies the Gödel–Malcev completeness theorem, and the latter entails LMT. The standard version of LMT works for countable languages (see Łoś 1955 for LMT for uncountable languages) and a compact consequence operation (omitting the property of compactness is not particularly significant). On the other hand, if LMT is strengthened by additional assumption concerning individual constants or by admitting uncountable languages, it becomes provably equivalent to AC (see also Gazzari 2014). These results help in placing LMT on the scale of infinitary methods in metamathematics.

The program of reverse mathematics (see Simpson 2009) gives a more general perspective in this respect. The symbol RCA₀ refers to Peano arithmetic minus the full induction scheme (it is restricted to ∑ zero–one formulas) plus the recursive comprehension scheme; it is a relatively weak subsystem of second–order arithmetic. LMT is equivalent over RCA₀ to the following propositions: weak König lemma, Gödel–Malcev completeness theorem, Gödel compactness theorem, completeness theorem for propositional logic for countable languages and the compactness theorem for propositional logic for countable languages. Since the weak König lemma is a rather mathematical (not metalogical) result, its equivalence with LMT exactly characterizes the mathematical content of the second. If LMT is associated with the consequence operation admitting the rule of substitution, we obtain the so–called relative Lindenbaum extensions (see Pogorzelski 1994, p. 318; this theorem was proved by Asser in 1959). Roughly speaking, if we take a consistent set X and a formula A such that A ∉ X, we have two consistent extensions of X, namely X ∪ {A} and X ∪ {¬A}. Clearly, by the standard LMT, there exist at least two different maximally consistent extensions. The problem how many such relative Lindenbaum sets are associated with a given consistent set X has no unique solution.

Here is a list of some other of Lindenbaum’s metamathematical results (see Tarski 1956, 32, 33, 36, 71, 297, 307, 338 for the technical details):

• the number of all deductive systems is equal to 2^ℵo;
• the number of all axiomatizable systems is equal to ℵ₀;
• the condition which must be satisfied in order for the sum of a deductive system to be a deductive system;
• structural type of a theory;
• theorems of degrees of completeness;
• atomic (atomistic, according to an older terminology) Boolean algebra.
• independence of primitive concepts in mathematical systems.

The last three results in the above list were achieved jointly by Lindenbaum and Tarski (see Tarski–Lindenbaum 1927), and other results inspired Tarski in his metamathematical investigations. Moreover, Tarski credited to Lindenbaum the pointing out the role of set–theoretical methods in metamathematical investigations (T1956, p. 75).

6. Final Remarks

Helena Rasiowa (in Rasiowa 1974, p. v) says that the introduction of the Lindenbaum–Tarski algebra became “one of the turning points in algebraic study of logic”. This tradition was continued,  systematized and conceptually unified by Tarski himself as well as by his American students, particularly J. C. C. McKinsey,  Bjarni Jónsson, Don Pigozzi as well as Polish logicians, notably Jerzy Łoś, Helena Rasiowa and Roman Sikorski.  Rasiowa–Sikorski 1970 can be considered as the opus magnum in this direction. A similar role should be attributed to LMT (not properly called the Lindenbaum Lemma, because its actual importance exceeds the fact of being an auxiliary device for proving other results) as a mark of mathematical content of tools used in metamathematics. Thus, Adolf Lindenbaum appears as one of the main masters in developing mathematics for metamathematics. His results on logical matrices opened a new stage in metalogical investigations concerning propositional calculus.

7. References and Further Reading

• Gazzari, R. 2014, “Direct Proofs of Lindenbaum Conditionals”, Logica Universalis 8, Issue 3–4, 321–343.
• Hinkis, A. 2013, Proofs of the Cantor-Bernstein Theorem. A Mathematical Excursion, Basel: Birkhäuser.
• Lindenbaum, A. 1930, “Remarques sur une question de la methode mathematique”, Fundamenta Mathematicae 15, 313–321.
• Lindenbaum, A. 1931, “Bemerkungen zu den vorhergehendem “Bemerkungen” des Herrn J. v. Neumann”, Fundamenta Mathematicae 17, 335–336.
• Lindenbaum, A. 1936, “Sur la simplicité formelle des notions”, in Actes du Congrès International de Philosophie Scientifique, VII Logique (Acutalités Scientifique et Industrieles 394), 29–38.
• Lindenbaum, A.–Mostowski, A. 1938, “Über die Unabhängigkeit des Auswahlaxioms und einiger seiner Folgerungen”, Comptes Renduz des Séances de la Société des Sciences et des Letters de Varsovie, Classe III, 31, 27–32; Eng. tr.  in A. Mostowski, Foundational Studies. Selected Works, Vol. II, Warszawa–Amsterdam: PWN–Polish Scientific Publishers – North–Holland Publishing Company, 70–74.
• Lindenbaum, A.–Tarski, A. 1926, „Communication sur la recherches de la théorie des ensembles”, Comptes Renduz des Séances de la Société des Sciences et des Letters de Varsovie, Classe III, 19, 299–330; repr. in A. Tarski, Collected Papers, vol. 1, 1921–1934, Basel: Birkhäuser 1986, 171–204.
• Lindenbaum, A.–Tarski, A. 1934–1935, “Über die Beschränktheit des Ausdrucksmittel deduktiver Theorien, Ergebnisse eines mathematischen Kolloqiums 7, 15–22; Eng. tr. in Tarski 1986, 384–392.
• Łoś, J. 1949, O matrycach logicznych (On Logical Matrices), Wrocław: Wrocławskie Towarzystwo Naukowe.
• Łoś, J. 1955, „The Algebraic Treatment of the Methodology of Elementary Deductive Systems”, Studia Logica 2, 151–212.
• Łukasiewicz, J.–Tarski, A. 1930, “Untersuchungen über den Aussgenkalkül”, Comptes Renduz des Séances de la Société des Sciences et des Letters de Varsovie, Classe III, 23, 30–50; Eng. tr. in Tarski 1956, 38–59.
• Marczewski, E.–Mostowski, A. 1971 “Lindenbaum Adolf (1904–1941)”, Polski Słownik Biograficzny 17, 364b–365b;
• Moore, G. H. 1982, Zermelo’s Axiom of Choice. Its Origins, Development, and Influence, Springer Verlag: New York – Heidelberg – Berlin.
• Pogorzelski, W. 1994, Notions and Theories of Elementary Formal Logic, Białystok: Warsaw University – Białystok Branch.
• Rasiowa, H. 1974, An Algebraic Approach to Non-Classical Logics, Amsterdam – Warszawa: PWN–Polish–Scientific Publishers – North–Holland Publishing Company.
• Rasiowa, H.–Sikorski, R. 1970, The Mathematics of Metamathematics, Warszawa: PWN– Polish Scientific Publishers.
• Sierpiński, W. 1965, Cardinal and Ordinal Numbers, Warszawa: PWN – Polish Scientific Publishers.
• Simpson, S. G. 2009, Subsystems of Second Order Arithmetic, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Surma, S. J. 1967, “History of Logical Applications of the Method of Lindenbaum’s Algebra”, Analele Univeritatii Bucurereşti – Acta Logica 10, 127–138.
• Surma, S. J. 1968, “Some Metamathematical Equivalents of the Axiom of Choice”, Prace z Logiki 3¸71–80.
• Surma, S. J. 1973, “The Concept of Lindenbaum Algebra and Its Genesis, in Studies in the History of Mathematical Logic, ed. by S. J. Surma, Ossolineum, Wrocław, 239–253.
• Surma, S. J. 1982, “On the Origins and Subsequent Applications of the Concept of Lindenbaum Algebra”, in Logic, Methodology and Philosophy of Science VI. Proceedings of the Sixth International Congress of Logic, Methodology and Philosophy of Science, Hannover 1979, ed. by L. J. Cohen, J. Łoś, H. Pfeiffer and K.–P. Podewski, Warszawa – Amsterdam: PWN Polish Scientific Publishers – North–Holland Publishing Company, 719–734.
• Tarski, A.–Lindenbaum, A. 1927, “Sur l’indépendance des notions primitives dans les systèmes mathématiques”, Annales de la Société Polonaise de Mathématique 7, 111–113.
• Tarski, A. 1949, Cardinal Algebras, New York: Oxford University Press.
• Tarski, A. 1956, Logic, Semantics, Metamathematics. Papers from 1923 to 1939, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
• Tarski, A. 1986, “What are Logical Notions?”, History and Philosophy of Logic 7, 143–154.
• Woleński, J. 1995, “Mathematical Logic in Poland 1900–1939: People, Institutions Circles, Institutions, Ideas”, Modern Logic V(4), 363–405; repr. in J. Woleński, Essays in the History of Logic and Logical Philosophy, Kraków: Jagiellonian University Press 1999, 59–84.
• Wójcicki, R. 1989, Theory of Logical Calculi. Basic Theory of Consequence Operations, Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers.
• Zygmunt, J.–Purdy, R. 2014, “Adolf Lindenbaum: Notes on His Life with Bibliography and Selected References”, Logica Universalis 8, Issue 3–4, 285–320.

Author Information

Jan Woleński
Email: wolenski@if.uj.edu.pl
University of Technology, Management and Information
Poland

F. H. Bradley: Logic

Although the logical system expounded by F. H. Bradley in The Principles of Logic (1883) is now almost forgotten, it had many virtues. To appreciate them, it is helpful to understand that Bradley had a very different view of logic from that prevalent today.  He is hostile to the idea of a purely formal logic. Today, deductive logic is largely restricted to a study of the rules through which we can legitimately re-arrange our thoughts, permitting the elimination of items no longer required, but not allowing the addition of anything genuinely new.  Bradley had a much wider conception and took logic to be the discipline through which we give an account and explanation of the special function of thought through which we transcend immediate experience.  Bradley believes logic covers topics that would fall today under the heading of theory of knowledge.

For Bradley, the processes of thought through which we transcend immediate experience involve ideas, judgments, and inferences.  He begins with judgment and offers a natural account of both relational judgments with more than one subject and judgments without a special subject, such as: “It is raining.”  His general theory that the ultimate subject of all judgment is reality as such could also accommodate the mass terms that give modern logicians so much trouble.

Although Bradley accepts the credo of empiricism that all our knowledge begins in experience, he does not accept Hume’s view that our immediate experience is composed by a swarm of impressions. He rejects the theory, widespread at the time, that knowledge could be explained through the association of ideas derived from such impressions.  Neither psychological particulars nor any connections among them are the sorts of thing capable of representing anything beyond themselves.  Judgment requires “logical” ideas that are universal, not particular.

What most baffles readers is an esoteric doctrine in which Bradley assimilates judgment and inference as processes in which there is a movement of thought from a ground to a conclusion.  Unless there is a change, nothing has happened, but any change requires justification, if the inference is to be valid or the judgment true.  For the movement of thought to be satisfactory, the ground and justification cannot remain external and must be brought inside.  This is achieved to the extent that we can enlarge our system of thought.  It may seem that Bradley is now heading to a Hegelian solution in which the completion of the system of thought brings about the identity of Thought and Reality, but Bradley is not prepared to go this far.  This is, however, a matter for metaphysics and is beyond the scope of logic.

Table of Contents

1. Biography
2. Bradley’s Conception of Logic
3. Judgment
4. Logical Ideas
5. Categorical Judgments
   1. Universal Judgments
   2. Analytic Judgments of Sense
   3. Synthetic Judgments of Sense
6. Hypothetical Judgments
7. The Esoteric Doctrine
8. Other Types of Judgments
   1. Negative Judgments
   2. Disjunctive Judgments
9. Other Topics
   1. Logical Principles
   2. Extension and Intension
   3. Modality
10. Judgment: Concluding Remarks
11. The Nature of Inference
12. The Association of Ideas
13. Inductive Inference
14. Inference: The Inclusive Theory
15. Inference and Judgment
16. Formal Logic
17. Truth and Validity
18. The Final Doctrine
    1. Inference
    2. Judgment
    3. The Fundamental Problem of Thought
    4. Immediate Experience and the Absolute
19. References and Further Reading
    1. Selected works by F. H. Bradley
    2. Further Reading

1. Biography

Francis Herbert Bradley was born in 1846 into a very large family that included the celebrated Shakespearean critic, A.C. Bradley.  Having studied at Oxford University, F. H. Bradley was awarded in 1870 a Fellowship at Merton College, where he remained until his death in 1924.  He was not required to teach and did not do so.  The dominant philosophy in England when he came to Oxford was the (kind of) empiricism, originally due to John Locke, whose champion in the nineteenth century was John Stuart Mill. This theory attempted to explain cognition through the association of mental particulars, impressions and ideas, originally introduced into the mind, it was supposed, by external causes.  Bradley was implacably opposed to this position and determined to demolish it.  He gained assistance in this from his wide reading in German philosophy, but refused to call himself a Hegelian, since he denied the central principle of the identity of Thought and Reality.  Nonetheless, he is generally regarded as the central figure in the group of British Idealists in the late nineteenth century.

2. Bradley’s Conception of Logic

The principal source for Bradley’s thoughts about logic is a substantial two-volume work entitled The Principles of Logic, published in Oxford in 1883.  A second edition appeared in 1922, in which the original text was supplemented by a large number of additional notes and terminal essays through which Bradley expressed his mature position. (Page references in what follows will be to this second edition.)

Bradley had a very different view of logic from that prevalent today.  Today, logic is largely restricted to a study of the rules through which we can legitimately re-arrange our thoughts, permitting the elimination of items no longer required, but not allowing the addition of anything genuinely new.  Bradley had a much wider conception and took logic to be the discipline through which we give an account and explanation of the special function of thought through which we transcend immediate experience.  Logic, for Bradley, therefore covers topics that would fall today under the heading of theory of knowledge.

The processes of thought were traditionally taken to involve ideas, judgments, and inferences.  These topics, however, are very closely connected.  One could begin at any point, but Bradley proposes to begin in the middle with the faculty of judgment.

3. Judgment

Bradley’s central definition is as follows: “Judgment proper is the act which refers an ideal content (recognized as such) to a reality beyond the act.” (10) This definition immediately raises two serious questions: (1) What is this ideal content and how is it acquired? (2) What is reality and how is it accessed?  These are questions that Bradley tackles in considerable detail.  Moreover, the definition commits Bradley to the thesis that the structure of judgment is essentially subject-predicate, “that in every judgment there is a subject of which the ideal content is asserted.” (13)   The subject is what is real, and the predicate is the ideal content referred to it: judgment is essentially predication.

This is, of course, to display the form of the act or function of judgment.  It does not specify the essential structure of the ideal content, nor does it trap Bradley within the traditional logic of the categorical statement, as Russell believed.  Categorical statements involve the combination of two terms—a subject term and a predicate term—with the two terms united by the copula in such a way that the act of combination is the act of judgment.  Bradley resists this account on the ground that the ideal complex expressed is the same whether the proposition is asserted or merely entertained.  “We may say then, if the copula is a connection which couples a pair of ideas, it falls outside judgment; and, if on the other hand it is the sign of judgment, it does not couple.  Or, if it both joined and judged, then judgment at any rate would not be mere joining.” (21)  It is not even true that every judgment contains two ideas: on the contrary, it has but one.  The ideal content may be as complex as you please: it may be “a complex totality of qualities and relations” (11); but even if we distinguish separate ideas within the complex, it is as a unit that it is referred to reality.  When we assert that the wolf eats the lamb, it is the whole complex that is referred beyond the act of judgment, even if we distinguish within it the separate ideas of (at least) the wolf and the lamb.

Because we can distinguish separate objects such as the wolf and the lamb that can function as special subjects, we can draw at the level of logic a distinction between singular judgments that characterize single things and plural judgments in which a number of such things may be related.  But even with non-singular judgments, we must assume a unified reality within which various objects are assigned a place.

Bradley’s theory that relational judgments that appear to refer to a number of identifiable and discriminable individuals actually presuppose a single underlying reality gets confirmation from his logical analysis of a kind of judgment in which this reality is introduced directly.  This is the kind of judgment that denies the existence of things of a certain type, such as sea-serpents.  “Sea-serpents do not exist” has “sea-serpents” as its grammatical subject, but we must distinguish the grammatical subject from the real subject that confers a truth-value upon the statement.  Sea-serpents are not the reality to which we refer when making this judgment, since there are no sea-serpents.  The correct logical analysis is something like: “Reality is such that it contains no sea-serpents.”  This corresponds to: “Reality is such that A and B are simultaneous.”  Bradley can therefore handle this kind of judgment without presupposing the existence of what is denied.  What he presupposes is the reality that is the ultimate subject of every judgment.  The competing analysis offered by modern logic through the negation of existential quantification presupposes a universe of discourse comprising all possible values of the individual variables in the system.

Judgment has a dimension of truth and falsity, and Bradley uses this to confirm his view that judgment necessarily involves a reference to what is real.  “For consider;” he says, “a judgment must be true or false, and its truth or falsehood cannot lie in itself.  They involve a reference to a something beyond.  And this, about which or of which we judge, if it is not fact, what else can it be?” (41)  It may be thought that logical truths, said to be true in all possible worlds, are an exception.  For Bradley, logical truths, or tautologies, are not true in all possible worlds: they are not true in any possible world. “A bare tautology …is not even so much as a poor truth or a thin truth.  It is not a truth in any way, in any sense, or at all.” (Appearance and Reality, Note A, 501.)

4. Logical Ideas

Bradley’s definition of judgment introduces “ideal content.”  What is “ideal content” and how is it acquired?  Bradley was completely sure that the psychological particulars with which empiricists furnished the mind could not begin to explain judgment, knowledge, and cognition.  If such things existed, they certainly could not function as predicates in judgment, since they could not be moved from their place in the mind.

What Bradley had to explain was how we get from psychological ideas, which are mental particulars, to logical ideas, which are universal ideal contents, while preserving the information that the impressions have no doubt acquired from elsewhere.  He begins by distinguishing two sides that belong to every psychological idea—its existence as a mental particular and its content.  “We perceive both that it is and what it is.” (3)  Unlike existence, content can be loosened from its home in the psychological idea and transferred elsewhere—a loosening of content that takes place within the act of judgment.  It is not, however, the entire content of the psychological idea that is used in judgment.  The original content, he says, is “mutilated.” That the acquisition of ideal content involves abstraction is more clearly appreciated, if we move from the Humean picture of a swarm of distinct impressions arriving together in the mind to the notion of an organic immediate experience with which Bradley is more comfortable.  It is clear that the logical ideas used in judgment require the separation of elements within the “sensuous felt mass” presented in immediate experience.  Even if we begin, however, with an isolated impression or sense-datum, we must recognize that universals are associated at different levels.

Bradley makes an unsuccessful attempt to explain what he has in mind by using the notion of a symbol.  A symbol, such as a particular inscription, has, like everything else, two sides: its existence and its content.  But it has also a third side—its meaning or signification.  This meaning can be identified with the logical idea used in judgment. The symbol RED has as its meaning exactly what we assign to a variety of objects in the act of judgment.  This provides an opening for Frege and those who favor the linguistic turn to slip in an item distinct from any image or psychological idea that may be associated with the word.  (The logical idea is, of course, to be identified with what Frege calls the sense of the sign, not the referent.)  But the attachment of the idea to the symbol through decision or convention does nothing to explain the connection between the abstract universal and the immediate experience which must be its home.  It is only because we can abstract a part of the given content that we obtain the sense that we attach to the sign in the language.

5. Categorical Judgments

a. Universal Judgments

The standard classification of judgments distinguished categorical, hypothetical, and disjunctive.  Bradley reduces the universal form of the categorical judgment to a hypothetical form.  The universal form does not even guarantee the existence of real things to which we refer.  “All trespassers will be prosecuted” is designed to ensure that the subject class remains empty.  Thus, “Animals are mortal” becomes “If anything is an animal, then it is mortal.” (47) Bradley admits that he got this from Herbart, and Russell admits, in turn, that he got it from Bradley.

b. Analytic Judgments of Sense

Singular judgments, however, are different.  Bradley takes as his example: “I have a toothache.”  I and my toothache are both individual, but I describe my condition in general terms as “suffering from toothache.”  This example belongs to the first division of singular judgments that he calls “analytic judgments of sense.”  “The essence of these is to hold only of the now, and not to transcend the given presentation.” (56)  Analytic judgments of sense do not always have a grammatical subject or copula.  We may call the cry “Wolf” a warning, but it is also a statement of fact, or is supposed to be.  The cry of “Wolf” or “Rain” refers to an undifferentiated present reality. The thought is that a wolf is somewhere and that rain is everywhere, at least everywhere that matters.  But there are also singular judgments without grammatical subjects in which we qualify by our idea “but one piece of the present.” (57)  One way to do this is by pointing.  I point to my dog and say “Asleep.”  Bradley rejects the view that the grammatical subject is merely suppressed. Even if a grammatical subject may appear when my judgment is reported.

Bradley identifies a second kind of analytic judgments of sense that do have a grammatical subject. “The ideal content of the predicate is here referred to another idea, which stands as a subject.  But in this case, as above, the ultimate subject is no idea, but is the real in presentation.  It is this to which the content of both ideas, with their relation, is attributed.” (57)  “This bird is yellow” is a typical example.  The ideal content “bird”, perhaps aided by a pointing finger, is used to identify the particular object that is the special subject of the judgment.

In addition to analytic judgments of sense in which a real object is introduced through what we would now call a definite description, there are other cases in which a proper name is used, such as “John is asleep.”  The name “John” is bestowed to help us identify a particular person.  Bradley attacks the view that a proper name has a denotation, but no connotation.  The proper name is a sign connected with what it denotes, but I could not identify what it denotes without some descriptive content to help me recognize it.

c. Synthetic Judgments of Sense

The discussion of proper names allows Bradley to move to a second category of singular judgment-synthetic judgments of sense.  “Proper names,” he says, “have a meaning that always goes beyond the presentation of the moment.” (61) In using the name of a person, we assume an existence that goes beyond what is available in immediate experience, a reality that appears but is distinct from its appearance.  In a synthetic judgment of sense, “we make generally some assertion about that which appears in a space or time that we do not perceive.” (61-2) But how is this possible?  How can we make a judgment about a reality that appeared in the past, will appear in the future, or is now over the horizon, if we encounter reality only through presentation in immediate experience?  No idea can capture the uniqueness of the day that is last Tuesday.  We can form the idea of a certain kind of event: we can form the idea of an extensive history involving as large a sequence of events as you please, but such ideal contents cannot capture the unique past that actually took place, which alone can make the ideas we refer to the past either true or false.

For Bradley, the solution requires a crucial distinction between “this” and “thisness”.  Only this day is today.  Yesterday was today yesterday, but it is no longer today today.  Today is also a particular day distinct from every other day and has its own date.  It has its own position in a series of days within which every day is rigidly ordered through the relation of earlier and later. This series of days does not change, even when it is envisaged at different times.  It is therefore a universal ideal content, and each day within the series has particularity or “thisness”.  After McTaggart, the series has been known as the B-series.  This ideal series can be attached to reality, only through the identification of a particular day within it with the reality given in present experience, which will turn that day into “today.”  Once this is done, days that come after the day with that date are future days that will be real, and days that come before are past days that were real.  This introduces the McTaggart A-series.  To explain Bradley’s theory, the unit “day” has been used, although it does not appear in the text and involves an oversimplification, since we cannot identify an entire day with the present of immediate experience.  On the other hand, it would be a complete mistake to identify the immediate present with an instant or a moment, imagined as either the end product of the infinite division of a period of time or as the interface between adjacent periods.

Since we cannot introduce a reference to what really happened in the past or will really happen in the future, which synthetic judgments of sense seem to demand, through the construction of even the most complex and extensive ideal content constituting a history of a possible world, how is the feat to be accomplished?  Bradley’s solution is that although I can access reality only through a point of contact in immediate present experience, reality is not restricted to its appearance in my experience.  The problem of appearance and reality is metaphysical and requires another book; but even at the level of logic it is clear that the identity of reality and what appears in experience is not mandated.  “If the real must be ‘this’, must encounter us directly, we cannot conclude that the ‘this’ we take is all the real, or that nothing is real beyond the ‘this’.” (70) Being given in experience is not a quality of reality “in such a sense as to shut up reality within that quality.” (70)  An ideal content can be true “because it is predicated of the reality, and unique because it is fixed in relation with immediate perception.” (72) Since immediate perception may involve an experience of change, a fragment of the temporal series may be abstracted and extended indefinitely through an ideal process.

Bradley has one further move to make to introduce the idea of a particular fact. “The idea of particularity implies two elements. We must first have a content qualified by ‘thisness’, and we must add to that content the general idea of reference to the reality.” (77) Without the second element, we have members that are exclusive within the series, “but the whole collection is not unique.” (77) For absolute uniqueness, we require the connection of the series with direct presentation.  To think of tomorrow we may require a universal ideal content to connect it with today, but the day we think about is as unique as is today.

6. Hypothetical Judgments

Bradley handled universal judgments by reducing them to hypothetical form, but how can a hypothetical judgment be taken as true, since its antecedent is supposed, but not categorically affirmed?  Modern logic evades this problem by treating hypothetical statements as truth-functional, but this evasion has consequences. For Bradley, the hypothetical judgment involves an ideal experiment.  “The supposal is treated as if it were real, in order to see how the real behaves when qualified thus in a certain manner.” (86)  The connection of the components is what is asserted in the hypothetical judgment, and it is this that has its ground in reality.

Bradley believes that not only are all universal judgments hypothetical, but also that all hypothetical judgments are universal.  This may be thought doubtful, since there seem to be exceptions.  “If this man has taken that dose, he will be dead in twenty minutes.” (89)  This would not be necessarily true of any man who took the dose; but if the judgment is true, there will be some universal connection, even if restricted to the case of that specific man.

Bradley is assuming that the truth of a hypothetical statement must depend on some (possibly) latent feature of reality.  Singular judgments, however, appear to connect us more directly with solid fact.  The synthetic judgment of sense has its special status as categorical because of its connection with a reality actually given.  It therefore depends on the analytic judgment of sense which assigns an ideal content to that given. Bradley has already argued that all universal statements are hypothetical.  This is now widely accepted.  He now moves to the startling claim that all singular statements are hypothetical, which he recognizes as an “unwelcome conclusion.” (91)   Construed as categorical, analytic judgments of sense are all false, because they do not provide the whole truth about what is given in immediate experience, far less the whole truth about reality.  This follows from his original story that an ideal content used in judgment is limited to part of the content of the given reality.  But to say that the judgment is not the whole truth is not to say that it is not wholly true and hence partly false, even false tout court. Bradley complains that the choice of an ideal content to qualify the immediate given is arbitrary.  Arbitrary is too strong, since the choice may very well have a purpose, but even if it were arbitrary, the assignment of universal content to the given reality would be just as true as the choice of any other content from the selection available.

Bradley is suggesting that the loosening of part of the content of the given reality that he introduced earlier as the very essence of thought is doomed to failure in advance.  This is why he talks about “mutilation”.   But the success or failure of the operation is surely relative to what it is intended to achieve.  It is not designed to provide an ideal content that will be a complete characterization of reality as a whole; it has surely a much more limited aim.   One idea is that loosening a part of the content is associated with separating out a segment of the given reality that conforms to the concept introduced.  Loosening the concept of a dog from what I am given allows me to separate out Fido and perhaps other dogs within my field of view.  The analytic judgment of sense that here is a dog would appear to be categorically true.  This way of explaining the function of the judgments immediately associated with the loosening of ideal contents would allow Bradley, were he so minded, to make peace with logical systems, such as both Aristotelian and modern logic, that give a central position to the individual object. (This is essentially the problem of “special subjects”, discussed in Campbell: 1967.)

7. The Esoteric Doctrine

We have now come to a parting of the ways.  If we accept the truth of analytic judgments of sense, such “judgments that analyze what is given in perception will all be categorical.” (106)  Abstract, universal judgments will all be hypothetical.  Synthetic judgments “about times and spaces beyond perception” (106) are also categorical, although they require inferences that rely on the universal.  Bradley is prepared to allow those who lack the courage to follow him to a more esoteric theory “to remain at a lower point of view.” (106)    Bradley, however, proposes a trip to a region where the “distinction between individual and universal, categorical and hypothetical, has been quite broken through.” (106)  It is at this higher level that Bradley’s logic becomes so difficult, perhaps impossibly difficult.  At the lower point of view, we separate out individual objects that we characterize through universal properties and relations in singular and plural judgments.  Bradley begins the move to what is higher (or deeper) with the point that these individual objects are conditioned by the setting in which they are found.  They are not unconditioned, but are asserted subject to a condition.  What is subject to a condition can be asserted categorically, if the condition is taken as satisfied.  Bradley is well aware that conditional and conditioned are not the same.  “A thing is conditional on account of a supposal, but on the other hand it is conditioned by a fact.” (99)  His argument is that for anything with a setting in space and time, the condition can never be satisfied.  To introduce the series of conditions in space and time is to introduce a chain whose last link hangs unsupported in the air. This is a worrying argument, traditionally used to prove that the world must have a beginning in time (perhaps also a First Cause), or else by Kant to vindicate transcendental idealism.  The assessment of how far it provides a solid support for what Bradley proposes to build on it will be postponed until 18b.

Rejecting the categorical judgment that assigns an ideal content to the segment of reality from which it has been loosened, Bradley is left with no more than hypothetical judgments.  These cannot even be our standard hypothetical judgments that are composites of categorical statements.  They are mere husks, connecting adjectives For example, “If lightning, then thundering.”  Certainly, hypotheticals that connect adjectives are in a way also categorical, since they affirm a ground of connection in reality.  But we have lost our standard hypothetical judgments and are left with mere scraps.  Even more baffling is the replacement we are offered for a singular judgment in the higher point of view.  “Instead of meaning by ‘Here is a wolf,’ or ‘This tree is green’ that ‘wolf’ and ‘green tree’ are real facts, it must affirm the general connection of wolf with elements in the environment, and of ‘green’ with ‘tree.’” (104)

Bradley offers a further explanation of his “unwelcome conclusion” in Terminal Essay II, which I discuss in 18b and offer a way of escape.  In the meantime, he returns from the heights and provides a more mundane account of other kinds of judgment.

8. Other Types of Judgments

a. Negative Judgments

Bradley now turns to negative judgments.  Negative judgments, he believes, are more complicated than affirmative, since they must begin with a suggestion that is rejected in the judgment.  Moreover, this rejection must depend on the assumption of a positive ground of exclusion, even if what this is may not be known. Negative existential judgments are of particular interest. In “Ghosts do not exist,” the grammatical subject cannot be the real subject; the real subject is the nature of things to which we deny the quality of harboring ghosts.  The positive character of reality that excludes ghosts is not, however, determined through the negative judgment.  This entails that the same character of the real may exclude a variety of different suggestions.  The suggestions excluded have their source in an ideal experiment and not in the nature of reality.  The negative judgment affirms that some quality of the real excludes a suggestion, but it does not determine what quality that is.  The truth of a negative judgment depends on a quality of the real incompatible with the quality excluded in the judgment.  The true quality and the quality assigned in the judgment are thus contraries and not contradictories.  The way in which a negative judgment presupposes a quality in what is real that we may not be able to specify may be compared with the way in which a hypothetical judgment presupposes the same kind of quality as grounding its connection.  It follows that the negation of a hypothetical judgment would be the rejection of this sort of ground.  The mere assertion of the antecedent and the negation of the consequent is indeed incompatible with the hypothetical judgment, but it is not its contradictory.  A genuine contradictory would be strong enough to rule out counterfactual conditionals.

b. Disjunctive Judgments

Bradley understands disjunction as providing a list of two or more mutually exclusive alternatives.  He is willing to associate disjunction with a nest of hypothetical judgments, but since neither the hypothetical judgments nor the disjunction are truth-functional, the disjunctive judgment may have a certain categorical aspect. “Disjunctive judgment is the union of hypotheticals on a categoric basis.” (131)

Bradley connects disjunction with choice, where we make a selection from a number of alternatives.  There is a definite list of possibilities; this is its categorical feature.  We cannot use disjunctive addition to add in an arbitrary fashion another disjunct that is not a real possibility.  In the same way, to say that something is colored is associated with a list of possibilities from which we select the actual color.  To produce the disjunctive judgment that lists the varieties of color is to assign to the object categorically the property of being some kind of color, even if we do not know which color it is.

This example conforms to the template that Bradley favors in place of the form “either p or q or…” that is used today. Bradley treats the disjunctive judgment as a kind of singular judgment, with the format “A is either b or c or d….” This analysis will run into difficulties when A does not exist, but Bradley has met this problem before, and deals with it by replacing the grammatical subject with the real subject.  This maneuver can even handle cases that seem most recalcitrant, such as “Either the light bulb is dead or the fuse has blown.”  This would become: “Reality is either characterized by light bulb malfunction or fuse meltdown.”

9. Other Topics

a. Logical Principles

Chapter V examines logical principles.  Bradley dismisses the Law of Identity as an empty tautology. Judgment requires the identity of differences, not provided by “A is A.” This means that the accusation (by Bertrand Russell) of confusing the “is” of predication with the “is” of identity cannot be fair, since for Bradley predication is the essence of judgment, whereas through the “is” of strict identity we do not make a judgment at all.         

The most interesting part of the section on “The Principle of Contradiction” is the discussion of (Hegelian) dialectic.  Bradley’s simple solution is that if the ideas combined in the synthesis are merely different, there is no problem. The ideas of self and other are different ideas, but no one would say that it is a contradiction to assert the existence of the self and other things as well.  The challenge to the principle of contradiction comes, only if the different ideas combined are taken to be discrepant or contrary, since the contrary of a given proposition entails its contradictory. Bradley offers a compromise according to which ideas that appear to be contrary are reconciled when harmonized within a wider reality.  For example, opposite properties can be assigned to the same thing at different times.

The Law of Excluded Middle takes the form of a disjunctive judgment and would be expressed today as “either p or not p.” Bradley, however, has a different form for disjunction, so that his version of the principle will be: “A is either b or not-b.” A is not always a real particular thing, but sometimes reality as such.  Indeed, if Bradley gets his way, the ultimate subject will always be reality.  Excluded middle uses the variety of disjunction in which the number of disjuncts is exactly two.  When the second disjunct is constructed as the negation of the first, there can be no other choice.

b. Extension and Intension

Bradley next tackles the familiar distinction between intension and extension in the chapter on the quantity of judgment, explaining that “in every symbol we separate what it means from that which it stands for.” (168)  (Frege’s distinction between sinn and bedeutung.)  His account of the extensional treatment of universal judgments such as “Dogs are mammals” is disappointing, because he fails to register that a set is a special kind of entity, suggesting that a set of dogs must be a pack of dogs, failing which the only alternative is the ludicrous idea of a collection of dog-images in the mind!  With a proper notion of set in place, “Dogs are mammals” can be taken to assert a relation between two sets, just as many other judgments assert a relation between two objects.

Judgments founded on intension refer to the connection of attributes and meanings, and ignore the denotation of objects.  Universal judgments based on meanings are those Kant considers strictly universal, because they do not permit even the possibility of exceptions. Not all universal judgments are of this type, and singular judgments never are. Our concept of what is real, denoted in a singular judgment, is the concept of the individual, which is both particular, excluding all other individuals, and universal, as unifying various characteristics and constituting an identity in difference.  The real individual is a concrete universal: abstract universals, which can be separated from the individual in thought and applied elsewhere, cannot be real.  In a similar way, what is truly individual is a concrete particular; abstract particulars that are nothing more than their distinction from other particulars are also unreal.  “A reality in space must have spatial diversity, internal to itself.” (188)   A point in space is distinct from all other points, but is a mere abstraction.  A moment in time is also an abstraction; a concrete individual existing in time must have some duration.

c. Modality

Bradley rejects as erroneous the view that modal differences do not affect the actual content of the judgments involved.  Certainly, you can take any judgment and “express any attitude of your mind towards it.” (198)   These propositional attitudes are many and various.  I may say: “I wish to make it” or “I fear to make it” or “I am forced to make it.”  “All these are simple assertorical statements about my condition of mind.” (198) Statements about possibility and necessity do not, however, express my state of mind.  They are assertions that claim objective truth.  “There clearly can be but one kind of judgment, the assertorical.  Modality affects not the affirmation, but what is affirmed.” (197)  This is in line with the logic of Principia Mathematica, in which everything takes place under the aegis of the assertion sign.  In this system, there is not even a corresponding negation sign, just a sign for the negation of a proposition.  This is more extreme than Bradley, who does allow a distinct function of negation.

Thus, judgments of necessity and possibility have a special content not to be found in the corresponding assertoric judgment.  For Bradley, “The possible and the necessary are special forms of the hypothetical.” (198) Necessity consists in a necessary connection between antecedent and consequent in a hypothetical judgment.  To say that a fact is necessary is not to elevate it to a higher status, but merely to say that it is a necessary consequence of some other state of affairs, also taken as fact.  As already explained, the connection through which the antecedent necessitates the consequent must itself depend on a categorical ground.  This includes cases where we assert a necessary connection, because of a regular succession of events.  Not that this ground has to be a necessary causal connection.  “The real connection which seems the counterpart of the logical sequence, is in itself not necessary.” (206)

Bradley also connects the possible with the hypothetical.  To say that something is possible is to say that some of its conditions are satisfied, excluding those specified in the antecedent of the associated hypothetical statement.  “It is possible to see an eclipse of the moon tonight” means “If you get up early enough and the weather co-operates, you will see an eclipse of the moon.”  To assert a potentiality or power or disposition is to commit to a hypothetical judgment stating that if certain other conditions are satisfied, a certain state of affairs will necessarily come to pass.

Bradley has a problem with modality because of his metaphysical vision of a Parmenidean Absolute Reality.  Modal distinctions come to life with the conception of an open future, in which some things are unavoidable and others are possibilities among which we may choose.  What is actual at the present time cannot be properly said to be either possible or necessary (Bradley gets this right!); although some things that have taken place were necessary and others were not.  Without this kind of background, the conceptual scheme Bradley is discussing would not exist.

10. Judgment: Concluding Remarks

In his presidential address to the American Philosophical Association in 1957 “Speaking of Objects,” W.V. Quine presents the manifesto for the position of modern logic.  “We persist in breaking reality down somehow into a multiplicity of identifiable and discriminable objects to be referred to by singular and general terms.  We talk so inveterately of objects that to say we do seems almost to say nothing at all; for how else is there to talk?” The reality to which Quine referred at the beginning disappears under the carpet and is heard from no more.  For Bradley, the reality that is broken down is, and has to be, the reality available in immediate experience.  It is broken down through the faculty of thought and judgment, which introduces distinct individuals characterized through universal logical ideas. This makes possible singular and plural judgments involving qualities and relations.  Not all judgments about what is real conform, however, to this template.  There are genuine judgments about reality that bypass a reference to real individuals.  Some such judgments modern logic may handle in other ways, but there are some that remain troublesome, such as judgments involving mass terms.  Bradley’s system of logic is more flexible and can handle the variety we find.

The strength of Bradley’s theory of judgment is the flexibility through which it accommodates a variety of forms.  Its weakness is that through insisting that the ultimate subject of judgment is reality, he seems to undermine the legitimacy of the singular and plural judgments on which we normally rely. One way to retain Bradley’s logic while rejecting the absolute monism of his metaphysical theory is to recognize that “reality” is itself a mass term.  The later developments in the logic of mass terms that are proving such a headache for modern logic also make more palatable the logic of Bradley.  Concepts, like “gold”, which do not by themselves package reality into units in the same way as count nouns like “dog”, can be used in various ways.  They can be used in a singular judgment to refer to a piece of gold: they can be used in plural judgments to refer to pieces of gold: and there is also a third use, as in “Gold is yellow,” where the concept is associated with a mass term.  (Interestingly, Bradley uses this very example (46) without noticing its special character.)  The possibility of this third use surely does not invalidate the other uses in singular and plural judgments.

This explanation of the process described by Quine is, of course, given at Bradley’s lower point of view, but the use of a mass term to designate the setting for the individual object, in place of a string of other individuals, may well discourage the desire to move to the mysterious higher view.  To isolate within the sensuous felt mass, designated by a mass term, an individual object associated with an ideal content loosened from what is given, seems about as good an account of the process of thought as we can get.

11. The Nature of Inference

Bradley moves on in Books II and III to the important topic of inference.  There is a problem emerging from the distinction between analytic and synthetic judgments of sense introduced in Book I, in that the synthetic judgments move us beyond what is given in immediate experience and must involve some kind of inference.   In a book on the principles of logic, Bradley must also engage with the traditional doctrine of the syllogism, which was taken to be the core of deductive inference.  Bradley proposes in the second book to deal with deductive inferences generally agreed to be valid, without probing too deeply, then moving in a third book to a fundamental theory intended to cover all forms of inference.

He begins by setting out three features of inference with which it is difficult to disagree.  First, the conclusion of an inference depends on a process of thought through which it is reached.  Second, the process rests on a basis.  “In inference, we advance from truth possessed to a further truth.” (245)  Third, there must be a difference between basis and conclusion; otherwise, the supposed inference is a “senseless iteration.” (246)

Bradley makes a list of forms of deductive inference, casting his net more widely to capture specimens that do not usually appear in the textbooks of the day.  The traditional syllogism cannot be taken as fundamental, since it does not cover all the forms that Bradley has listed, such as those empowered by transitive relations.  Bradley describes the process of inference as an operation of synthesis which “takes its data and by ideal construction combines them into a whole.” (256) Logical connection, however, requires the identity of common links, such as the middle term in a syllogism.  The first step is to form the whole: the second step is to extract the conclusion perceived within the whole by omitting parts that are no longer of interest.  Bradley denies that there is any general principle that will serve as a test of the validity of reasoning. The traditional syllogism is not up to the job and no replacement can be found.

The common link required to combine premisses is both the same and different.  “If it were not different it would have nothing to connect, and if it were not the same there could be no connection.” (288)  But how can we have both identity and difference?  The solution is that the common term is an ideal content “appearing in and differenced by two several contexts.” (288)

The process of inference depends entirely on this identity in difference.  There are, however, two radically different kinds of identity that Bradley does not distinguish at this point.  There are universal characters which are identical throughout their various instantiations (abstract universals) and there are individual objects that remain identical throughout their various appearances (concrete universals).  These individuals may even combine characters that are in some sense discrepant, if they are extended in space or enduring in time.  Caesar was in Gaul, and Caesar was in Italy.  Both types of identity in difference can provide a ground for inference, even within traditional syllogistic logic.  By suggesting that inference takes place only through the development of an ideal content and not via reference to an individual object, Bradley undermines the singular judgment and prepares the ground for a logical doctrine that downgrades it.

12. The Association of Ideas

The “association of ideas” is the name for a process that exists as a psychological fact; what Bradley is attacking is the empiricist account of this fact and the use of it to explain judgment and inference.  The empiricist theories of David Hume and John Stuart Mill attempt to explain the life of the mind in terms of the association of ideas that are distinct existences or psychological atoms.  The laws of association usually recognized are contiguity and similarity.  Bradley argues that the empiricists do not have the resources even to state clearly their central position, and offers the following restatement: “Any element tends to reproduce those elements with which it has formed one state of mind.” (304) He calls this law “redintegration”, getting the term from Sir William Hamilton.  The use of the qualification “tends” is standard for laws of association.  Bradley insists that his law “does not exclude any succession of events which comes as a whole before the mind,” (305) which is, of course, vital for the explanation of causal inference.

In spite of a superficial resemblance, there is a chasm that divides Bradley’s redintegration and the association of the empiricists.  Association is cohesion between psychical particulars: redintegration concerns the connection of universals, “which is an ideal identity within the individuals.” (306)  Only an ideal connection in the mind can survive the disappearance of connected individuals.  The impressions originally given in conjunction are gone and cannot be resurrected.  Only the universal ideal content, the “what” as opposed to the “that” is left behind as a memory trace.  Through the universals, we may perhaps be able to produce images that are, as it were, ghosts of the past, but these images will be fresh particulars and distinct existences that can be considered re-incarnations of the past, only in virtue of an ideal identity preserved through the universal.

In the empiricist theory developed, for instance, by John Stuart Mill, the bare contiguity of impressions was not considered to be by itself sufficient to operate the mechanism of association.  Past contiguity can be operative only if the memory thereof is introduced through the similarity between a component in a past experience and a sensation now being enjoyed.  But we still face the problem: “What has been called up has never been contiguous; and what has been contiguous cannot be called up.” (318) Not even similarity can resurrect what is now dead and gone.  Similarity can exist, only if the similar terms both exist. Therefore, reproduction through similarity is not possible, since the similarity requires that what is reproduced is already there.

There are few traces surviving today in either psychology or philosophy of the theory demolished by Bradley.  The violence of the rhetoric, although amusing, might be considered excessive, but in its day the theory was solidly entrenched, and dynamite may have been justified.

13. Inductive Inference

It seems that we often make inferences from particulars to particulars.  We take note that Fido barks when approached by a stranger; we infer that Rover will do the same.  Bradley denies that such inferences tacitly involve the inductive generalization that all dogs bark when approached by strangers, since people quite happy to make the inference from Fido to Rover might be reluctant to issue a general guarantee for all inferences of this type.  This does not mean, however, that universals are not involved.  The inference to the barking of Rover is based on a connection of ideal content, acquired through the encounter with Fido.

Bradley now turns to inductive generalization through which we reach a conclusion about all members of a certain class when only some members have been examined. This arena is the stamping ground of John Stuart Mill against whom Bradley directs his fire. Even if Mill’s Methods may be useful, standard textbooks agree that they are not logically sound. Bradley endorses the usual criticisms, and adds the point that in any case they do not take us from mere particulars to general truths, since the facts from which they begin are already conceptualized as instances of general kinds.

14. Inference: The Inclusive Theory

The story so far is that inference operates by combining premises that contain a ground of identity.  A conclusion is reached by eliminating the middle term.   Bradley now recognizes that this theory will not cover all forms of reasoning and sees the need for a third book in which to put things right. The original theory will handle the syllogism and many other arguments. What it does not cover is arguments where there is no elimination of a middle term, where the conclusion emerges as a structure incorporating A, B, and C on the basis of information relating A to B and B to C.  An example may clarify what Bradley has in mind.  We connect a day to the day before through the identity of the intervening night and the same day to the day after through a similar process.  In this way we construct a succession of days that will constitute a history.  This result will count as the conclusion of an inference in the wide sense.

Mathematics is also important in our cognitive life, and often not covered by the theory in Book II.  Other exceptions are the processes of comparison and distinction.  These are mental operations resulting in judgment, and are therefore inferences. Recognition is also inference, when we make the move from the perception of the man entering the room to the recognition of someone seen before.

Hegelian Dialectic also transcends the pattern permitted in the original theory.  Bradley offers a heretical version that tones down the excesses of the orthodox view.  Instead of supposing that the process begins in contradiction, Bradley suggests that our unrest begins in the recognition that the original datum is incomplete.  The dialectical move is to complete the incomplete through positing a larger whole in which it is a component.  This larger whole is itself seen to be incomplete, and the process is repeated.  The way in which the incomplete is completed has its source in the subject.  Although a dialectical move may have a source in past experience, the inferential move goes directly from the datum to what lies beyond, even if we are able sometimes to uncover a hypothetical judgment expressing the function that controls the inference.

Bradley is now ready to unveil general characteristics of inference.  Because it is intended to cover all cases, this will have to be vague.  In the beginning is a datum or data, followed by a mental operation, producing a result.  For example, in the inference: “A to the right of B, and B of C, and therefore A to the right of C” (432), we begin with “two sets of terms in relations of space” (432) and put them together.  This act of construction makes a difference, “but it does not make such a difference to the terms that they lose their identity.” (432-3)   Nor do A and C change their identity when directly related in the conclusion.   Inference makes a change, but it does not change the world.  Bradley often describes inference as “ideal experiment.” It is a movement of thought that we make, but we are not compelled to take this path.  If we have several premises, we are not compelled to put them together.  The act of combination is arbitrary, in the sense that it is something that we choose, but might not have chosen.  The act of inference is not a revision of the original data, although it introduces a fresh thought.

This makes sense where there is more than one premiss and an act of combination is required that depends upon the will of the agent.  But Bradley discovers many inferences where the conclusion issues through the development of a single premiss. Certainly, there is no inference without mental activity in which we begin with a datum and end with a judgment predicating a fresh characteristic; but does such intellectual activity all count as inference? Standard inference involves “a construction round an identical centre” (457), but there are non-standard inferences in which there seems to be no given identity.  However, the middle process, the operation leading from datum to conclusion, cannot “dispense with all identity.” (457)   The mere co-presence of all my thoughts is not enough, since this does not explain the special identity that enables the inference. Take “recognition” and “dialectic”, where we are given a real thing with a quality and infer another quality.  The inference depends on the connection of these qualities, and we might want to say that the middle term is the given quality.  The problem is that the connection of the qualities is neither explicit nor given. “It is a function of synthesis, which never appears except in its effects.” (458) “It is a construction by means of a hidden centre.” (458)Bradley distinguishes two operations associated with inference: synthesis and analysis.  In synthesis the many become one; in analysis the one becomes many.  Bradley makes a further distinction between analysis and elision.  We may begin with a judgment about a given whole, move by analysis to a plural judgment about its elements, and then by elision reach a conclusion about specific elements.  Central cases of inference in which premises are combined and a middle term eliminated involve both synthesis and analysis, but there are other inferences in which one or other operation is at least predominant.

Although they are different functions, analysis and synthesis have an intimate connection.  In analysis, the elements in the result are separated, but this means that they are also combined in a latent synthetic unity.  In synthesis, elements are combined, but the unity formed will be capable of analysis into the original components.  “Analysis is the synthesis of the whole which it divides, and synthesis the analysis of the whole which it constructs.” (471)  The crucial idea is the idea of the whole that analysis disassembles and synthesis constructs.  In analysis we operate on an explicit whole that falls into the background.  In synthesis we bring out the invisible totality comprehending the elements combined.

15. Inference and Judgment

With this wider conception of inference, it is getting harder to separate inference and judgment.  Certainly, synthetic judgments of sense involve a substantial inferential component, but even a judgment that comes straight from presentation seems to involve the analysis and synthesis that is characteristic of inference.  Judgment involves abstraction from the sensuous felt mass, and hence analysis.  Judgments assigning various characters to reality involve synthesis.  Bradley is certainly anxious to retain the distinction between judgment and inference.  “Inference is an experiment performed on a datum,” whereas in judgments of perception “there is properly no datum.” (479)  They do, indeed, have a basis, but this basis is for the intellect nothing.  “It is a sensuous whole which is merely felt and is not idealized.” (479)  Judgment is required to provide the ideal content from which inference takes its start.  In judgments of perception we have no rational ground to justify our result and “the stuff, upon which the act is directed, is not intellectual.” (480)  We can now, perhaps, make this clearer by explaining that the stuff in question is designated by a mass term.

The distinction between judgment and inference may not, however, be as sharp as one might like, as becomes clear when Bradley discusses the beginnings of our intellectual life.  “The earliest judgment will imply an operation which, although it is not inference, is something like it; and the earliest reasoning will begin with a datum, which though kin to judgment, is not intellectual.” (481) “Experience starts with a stimulation coming in from the periphery [what John McDowell calls ‘a brute impact from the exterior’]; but….the stimulation must be met by a central response.” (481) Sensations do not “simply walk into the mind.”  They are “the product of an active mental reaction.” (482)  The senses may give us sensations, but “the gift contains traces of something like thought.” (482)   The interface between cognition and the sensory input is murky indeed, but two things are clear. The response to the stimulus is not entirely arbitrary, nor is it a simple re-enactment of a given.  Nothing is given until it is received!

16. Formal Logic

Bradley is hostile to the idea of a purely formal logic whose goal is to construct a system of valid patterns of inference, covering all cases through the use of blanks and variables.  Partly, he does not believe that the goal can be achieved.  More basically, his concern is that the attempt to reconstruct inference in terms of the manipulation of counters in accordance with rules breaks the connection between inference and that continued reference to reality that lies at its heart.

Inferences do, indeed, proceed in accordance with principles, and we can reject a principle employed by finding another similar inference in which the premiss is true and the conclusion false.  In a particular inference, we can distinguish the principle from the matter involved, but we should not separate it and turn it into a major premiss in order to exhibit the argument as a syllogism.  The principle is not a premiss, because it is not a datum but a function. There may sometimes be a point in replacing the original argument with such a syllogism, but this option will not always be available. Every inference depends on a principle that is not a premiss, as Lewis Carroll has shown in “What the Tortoise Said to Achilles.” Even Principia Mathematica has the Law of Substitution and the Law of Detachment that are not axioms of the system!

17. Truth and Validity

So far the focus has been on the phenomenology of inference.  But inference is important, not because it takes place, but because it is taken to have validity and justification.  The problem is to explain how inference can have validity and justification in the face of the fundamental dilemma that Bradley identifies.  Unless there is a transition from the premiss to a different conclusion, nothing has happened, and there is no inference; but if there is a difference between premiss and conclusion, how can we justify the intellectual move?  Bradley dismisses the extreme claim that since they are different, there is an actual contradiction between premiss and conclusion.  To assert the premisses is not to deny the conclusion: it is merely to fail to assert it until the inference is completed.  But how is the eventual assertion of a different conclusion to be justified?

Logicians who do not challenge the legitimacy of the analytic judgment of sense can form a concept of truth that will allow them to explain that what is crucial for a valid inference is not that there be no change from premiss to conclusion, but  merely that there be no change in the truth value from true to false.  In the case of valid deductive inference this is guaranteed, because we merely re-arrange our information to make a certain element more salient.  What changes is merely our knowledge of the relation implicit in the premisses.  The act of inference requires an intervention by the subject that is arbitrary in the sense that it might not have taken place; but in the case of valid deductive inference, it is not an intervention that tampers with the truth.  There is, perhaps, more interference by the subject when a decision is made to eliminate part of the original ideal content, as when we drop the middle term in the conclusion of a syllogism.  Dropping ideal content even makes it possible that the conclusion is true, when the premisses contain error; but this does not matter, so long as it remains the case that if the premisses are true, the conclusion must also be true.

Perhaps deductive inference can be handled, if we do not probe too deeply, but Bradley now comes to a “rising sea” of non-deductive inferences that are not so easily controlled.  In mathematical construction we may infer the extension of a given straight line to double its size, but this is not the deduction of a conclusion from a premiss.   Comparison and distinction are also acts of the mind that are not deductive inference.  It could be argued, indeed, that these acts are not in fact inferences at all, but rather forms of plural judgment, originally involving more than one object distinguished within immediate experience.  Bradley, however, would not be greatly interested in this, since in his final view the distinction between judgment and inference is to be broken down.

The really serious problem, however, is empirical inference, including the prediction of the future on which we rely so heavily to carry out our purposes.  Bradley took the first step at the beginning of The Principles of Logic when he introduced the loosening from the given experience of an ideal content that can be transferred elsewhere.  This may explain how it is possible to formulate a belief about what will happen, but it does not explain why we choose to adopt the beliefs we do, or how these beliefs are to be justified.  Suppose we abstract from immediate experience a conjunction of ideal elements.  This may tempt us to imagine a similar conjunction in our representation of the future, but this would be justified, only if the connection of the elements were unconditioned and necessary.  Since in abstracting the conjunction from the given experience it has been separated from the context in which it was found, it remains, as Bradley believes, conditioned by that context.   Since this context is never completely known, the successful transfer of an ideal complex abstracted from the given context to a fresh context that may well be different cannot be guaranteed.

The recognition of the context in which the given ideal content is embedded undermines its guaranteed transfer elsewhere.  Does it also undermine the analytic judgment of sense that predicates the content of immediate experience?  This is what we are led to think in the move to the higher point of view, and it would be extremely serious, since it would destroy the very concept of true judgment.  It is ironic that at the beginning of The Principles of Logic Bradley uncovers the source of true judgment in the predication of an ideal content of an immediate experience from which it has been loosened and with which it is necessarily connected.  This explains how it is possible to transfer an ideal content extracted from immediate experience to a segment of reality not immediately experienced.  Such judgments, of course, may be either true or false.

This system is available as a lower point of view for those who are unable to follow Bradley all the way.  (It is also there as a fallback position, in the event that a fatal flaw is discovered in Bradley’s advanced reasoning, although Bradley himself does not seem to fear this possibility.)  The lower point of view is happy enough with the argument that empirical inferences have no logical guarantee, since the given object involved in the premiss is embedded in a context, ultimately unknown.  This argument establishes a conclusion to which everyone would agree.  What cannot be accepted is the use of the same fact to break the tie between ideal content and object that constitutes true judgment.  Without a viable concept of true judgment, even inference as we normally understand it will disappear, since the premisses and conclusion of an inference are all judgments, and a deductive argument is valid, if the conclusion must be true when the premisses are all true.

18. The Final Doctrine

a. Inference

We have been following the argument in the first edition of The Principles of Logic, in which Bradley tries to keep out the influence of his own metaphysical ideas, when operating at the lower level.   This is fortunate, because it makes Bradley’s often insightful discussion available to logicians who would be appalled by his metaphysics.  Bradley, as we know, is not ultimately satisfied with the lower point of view and feels compelled to move to a different position, where the influence of his metaphysical views can be detected. This difficult theory was not well understood, so that in the second edition of The Principles of Logic he included a set of terminal essays, which he hoped would provide a clearer exposition of his final views.

The original book began with judgment; the terminal essays begin with inference which he now moves to the center.   “Every inference is the ideal self-development of a given object taken as real.” (598)  This definition attempts to explicate inference without using the notion of judgment, which will later be explained as a kind of inference.  Even the third member of the logical trinity, the universal idea, is partly concealed under cover as “the given object.”  The given object must be ideal, since this is the only kind of entity capable of ideal self-development.  Bradley’s definition of inference would have been much clearer, if he had explained it as the ideal self-development of a logical idea taken as real.  The concept of ideal self-development, however, contains a problem, encountered before.   If there is no change, there is no inference; but if there is change, then “the inference is destroyed.”(599)   Bradley cannot take the usual line that the transition in inference from judgment to judgment is valid, so long as the preservation of truth is guaranteed.  This would be circular, since he intends to explain judgment in terms of inference. Bradley’s solution relies on the double nature of the datum, considered in itself and as part of a systematic whole. This is what is involved in the reference of the ideal content to reality.  This reference to reality, familiar from Bradley’s initial account of judgment, now turns out to mean “taken to be real, as being in one with Reality, the real Universe.” (598)  This is the point of “taken as real” in the original definition.  To take an ideal content as real is to identify it with Reality, in so far as it belongs to Reality.

We can now perhaps understand why Bradley replaces “logical idea” with “given object” in his initial definition.  A logical idea can only be a part of a system of logical ideas, a system of thought.  A given object, as normally understood and as understood within Bradley’s lower point of view, is a part of the real universe.  It is the act of judgment that connects the domain of thought with the real world.  It is judgment that predicates a logical idea of reality or of an object that belongs to reality.  Without judgment, the only possible movement of thought is a movement along a stream of ideas.  The only thing more real than a logical idea is a complete system of all ideas, and we have fallen into the clutches of Hegel!  To adopt the term “given object” to denote logical ideas makes it difficult to use the same term to introduce concrete individuals constituting the universe.

The movement of inference can be illustrated in the Dialectical Method, in which we expand a given content through recognition of its incompleteness.  The explicit premiss is “some distinguished content set before us.” (601) Implicit is “the entire Reality as an ideal systematic Whole.”  “Every member in this system…develops itself through a series of more and more inclusive totalities until it becomes and contains the entire system.” (601)  When I use this method, everything is necessary except where I begin and when I stop. For Bradley, however, such inferences are never fully satisfactory, since their ground is largely implicit and unknown.

Bradley goes on to consider in some detail other processes such as analysis, abstraction and comparison.  His discussion of arithmetic is of surprising interest, because the construction of the natural number series does seem to make sense of the notion of ideal self-development.  Each natural number develops itself through the successor function to introduce the number that follows it.  The number three is an ideal content, since it is a universal property shared by all triples, so that the transition to four must lie in the domain of ideality.

The representation of space and time is constituted through a similar process involving the ideal self-development of a given space or time.  Although these examples may illuminate the obscure notion of ideal self-development, they will not help to explain inference, if the construction of the successor of a natural number or the space and time that lies beyond what is given is not an inference.  Inference is usually considered a movement of thought from judgment to judgment, from premiss to conclusion.  This is not what happens when we extend a line or form a new number.

b. Judgment

Bradley, however, would not accept this, since he considers judgment itself to be a kind of inference in the wide sense.  It is a kind of inference in which the ground that compels the judgment is not made explicit.  Inference is present, even in the purest case of an analytic judgment of sense.  As we have seen, Bradley recasts the judgment “S is P” in the form: “Reality is such that S is P.”  The word “such” is the placeholder for the ground in reality that compels the conclusion “S is P.”  Since this condition is unspecified and not completely specifiable, the inferential structure is merely implicit.  This is a radical change, under the influence of Bosanquet, from Bradley’s original position, where judgment lies at the interface between the ideal and the actual, between the universal and particular, and is hence distinct from inference which is a movement within thought.

Bradley supports his change of heart by giving an example.  Suppose I immediately experience A to the right of B and therefore form the judgment that A is to the right of B.  There is, presumably, some sort of causal explanation for the relative position of these things.  My objection is that any such condition for the existence of a state of affairs is not a truth condition for the corresponding judgment.  It would be a truth condition only if it were incorporated in the judgment, which it is not.  Even if I am prepared to say that A is to the right of B because John put it there, I am not saying that A is to the right of B, if John put it there.  My statement is categorical, not conditional, and I will insist that A is to the right of B, even if it turns out that John is not responsible.

The objects A and B that are the special subjects of the plural judgment are necessarily selected from and connected with “our whole Universe.” (Presumably, this is our Universe, because it is connected with our immediate experience.)  In a singular judgment the special subject is this reality, which is “some special and emphasized feature in the total mass.” (629)  All such special subjects are conditioned by what lies beyond.  Even without invoking the law of causality, they are all conditioned by their setting in space and time.  Bradley argues that since the special subject of the judgment must be conditioned, even if its conditions are not known, the judgment itself cannot be unconditioned.  “The object therefore remains conditioned by that which is unknown, and only on and subject to this unknown condition is the judgment true.” (631)  This sentence explicitly identifies the existence conditions of the object with the truth conditions of the judgment.  If we refuse to make this jump, we can remain comfortably at Bradley’s “lower point of view” and ignore the obscure and baffling complexities of the esoteric theory.

c. The Fundamental Problem of Thought

Even if we insist on a sharper distinction between judgment and inference than Bradley would allow, there is a general idea of a movement of thought that covers both activities.  There may be some movements of thought we prefer to call judgments and others we call inferences, but Bradley’s purpose is to dig out what all acts of thought have in common.  He believes he can state the fundamental problem without a final distinction between judgment and inference.  Thinking is a process that reaches a result, and this implies the transcending of some initial state.  It is not enough, however, that there be a mere succession of states. The movement of thought requires justification.  The movement of thought must “satisfy the intellect.” In the case of inference, the satisfactory is called “valid”; in the case of judgment, the satisfactory is called “true.”  In both cases the problem of the satisfaction condition is essentially the same.  “Thought demands to go proprio motu…with a ground and reason…. Now to pass from A to B, if the ground remains external, is for thought to pass with no ground at all.”  (Appearance and Reality, Note A, 501)  We might suppose that in the case of deductive inference, there is an internal ground within the domain of ideas, although Bradley would not agree.  But there is clearly no such internal justification for the inferential move in the case of non-deductive or empirical inferences.  The success of empirical inferences or predictions depends on the way the world is or will be.  Our general level of success depends on our living in a reasonably well-ordered world in which we have developed reliable systems for the acquisition of information.

Since the ground that justifies the movement of thought is the nature of reality, this ground can never be brought within thought without the identity of thought and reality.  Nothing less than this will satisfy the intellect.  This is the essentially Hegelian move to identify thought and reality by turning reality into a system of thought.  Not that a finite center can ever reach an unconditioned completion of its thought.  We may try to get as close as we can, and the closer we get to a final completion, the more truth our thought contains.  As we expand our system of thought to make it more comprehensive, the truer it will become, so long as it remains harmonious and coherent.   Although the goal of Thought in Dialectic may be to complete the incomplete, Bradley believes that there is more to reality than even a completed system of thought could provide.  Bradley is not a Hegelian, because he denies that the completion of thought, even if it were possible, would be identical with the Absolute.  He rejects the replacement of reality by “some spectral woof of impalpable abstractions, or unearthly ballet of bloodless categories.” (591)  Although Bradley follows Kant in accepting the transcendental ideality of the series of phenomena, a position that provided a stepping stone for Hegel, Bradley refuses to accept this creation of the mind as the reality encountered in immediate experience.  For Bradley, “it is the whole continuity of the total series which is absolutely based on ideal reconstruction.  By means of this function, and this function alone, we have connected the past in one line with the present.” (587)

d. Immediate Experience and the Absolute

Immediate experience is associated with a cluster of ideas: “this”, “my”, “now”, “here”.  What is immediately experienced is felt.  “Feeling may be either used of the whole mass felt at any one time, or it may again be applied to some element in that whole.” (659)  What I immediately experience is real enough, but this does not mean that everything real must be experienced by me.  As less than reality as a whole, Bradley calls my immediate experience an appearance of reality.  To Bradley, “it seems clear that we not only start from the given ‘this,’ but remain resting on that foundation throughout.  Our whole ordered universe we may call a construction resting on immediate experience.” (661)

Bradley clearly retains the phenomenal realism at the heart of traditional empiricism, while rejecting the idea that immediate experience is a collection of distinct existences, which was responsible for its demise.  Experience, for Bradley, is originally a sensuous, felt mass.  This is particularly acceptable with the re-instatement of mass terms, excluded by the logic of Principia Mathematica.

For Bradley, a collection of distinct existences is not given, but emerges through an analysis carried out by thought.  “I have to turn my experience into a disjunctive totality of elements.” (665) This is uncannily like Quine’s idea that “we persist in breaking reality down somehow into a multiplicity of identifiable and discriminable objects.”  The connection is particularly striking, once we realize that special subjects, as well as Reality as a Whole, may extend beyond what is presented in immediate experience.  The ideal contents, necessary to separate objects within the sensuous felt mass, do not confine these objects to their presentation in immediate experience.  Because the contents are universal, they permit what Hume would call the continued existence of such real things beyond their appearance in my mind.

Bradley’s theory must be taken very seriously because of the detailed account that it offers of a process that Quine leaves shrouded in mystery.  It may be understood as a way of fixing what is wrong with empiricism.  It is harder to sympathize with the arguments that led Bradley to abandon what he calls the “lower point of view” and which may be based on a mistake.

19. References and Further Reading

a. Selected works by F. H. Bradley

• The Principles of Logic. Oxford University Press, 1883; second revised edition including terminal essays, 1922.
  • (This is the main source for Bradley’s logical theory.)
• Appearance and Reality. Oxford University Press, 1893; second edition with appendix, 1897.
  • (The metaphysical theory.)
• Essays on Truth and Reality. Oxford University Press, 1914.
  • (A collection of articles, for the most part originally published in Mind, and many on broadly logical topics.)
• Collected Works. Thoemmes Press: Bristol, England and Sterling, Va., 1999.
  • (Volume I contains Bradley’s notes for The Principles of Logic.)

b. Further Reading

• Allard, J. W., 2005, The Logical Foundations of Bradley’s Metaphysics: Judgment, Inference, and Truth. Cambridge University Press.
• Basile, Pierfrancesco, 1999, Experience and Relations: an Examination of F. H. Bradley’s Conception of Reality.  Chapter 4.
• Blanshard, Brand, 1939, The Nature of Thought.  Two Volumes.  London: George Allen & Unwin.
  • (Especially, Chapter XIII:  Bradley on Ideas in Logic and in Psychology.)
• Bosanquet, Bernard, 1885, Knowledge and Reality, A Criticism of Mr. F. H. Bradley’s ‘Principles of Logic’.  London: Kegan Paul, Trench.
• Bradley, James (ed.), 1996, Philosophy after F. H. Bradley. Bristol: Thoemmes.
• Bradley Studies, the journal of the Bradley Society, was published from 1995 to 2004.
  • (It has now been succeeded by Collingwood and British Idealist Studies.)
• Campbell, C. A., 1931, Scepticism and Construction: Bradley’s Sceptical Principle as the Basis of Constructive Philosophy. London: George Allen & Unwin.
• Campbell, C. A., 1957, On Selfhood and Godhood. London; George Allen & Unwin.
  • (Gifford Lectures delivered at the University of St. Andrews.)
• Campbell, C. A., 1967, In Defence of Free Will. London: George Allen & Unwin.
  • (Chapter XII.  The Mind‘s Involvement in Objects.  This was originally published in 1962 as a contribution to Theories of the Mind, edited by Jordan M. Scher, published by the Free Press of Glencoe, a division of the Macmillan Company.)
• Candlish, S., 2007, The Russell/Bradley Dispute and its Significance for Twentieth-Century Philosophy. Basingstoke: Palgrave Macmillan.
• Ferreira, P., 1999, Bradley and the Structure of Knowledge. Albany: SUNY Press.
• Ferreira P., 2014, ‘Idealist Logic’ in The Oxford Handbook of British Philosophy in the Nineteenth Century, Oxford: Oxford University Press, pp. 111-132.
• Hylton, Peter, 1990, Russell, Idealism, and the Emergence of Analytic Philosophy.  Oxford University Press.  Chapter 2.
• Levine, James, 1998, “The What and the That: Theories of Singular Thought in Bradley, Russell and the Early Wittgenstein” in Appearance Versus Reality: New Essays on Bradley’s Metaphysics. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
• Mander, W. J. (ed.), 1996, Perspectives on the Logic and Metaphysics of F. H. Bradley. Bristol: St. Augustine’s Press.
• Mander, W.J., 2008, ‘Bradley’s Logic’ in D. Gabbay and J.H. Woods (eds.) Handbook of the History of Logic.  Volume Four: British Logic in the Nineteenth Century, Elsevier, pp. 663-717.
• Mander, W., 2011, British Idealism. A History.  Oxford University Press.
• Manser, A., 1983, Bradley’s Logic.  Oxford University Press.
• Peacocke, C., 1992. A Study of Concepts. Chapter 3.  Cambridge MA and London: MIT Press.
  • (This entry requires explanation, since Bradley is never mentioned in the book.  Chapter 3 introduces scenarios, which are non-conceptual representational contents.  As general, they qualify as ideal contents in Bradley’s sense.  The positioning of scenarios in reality is therefore a special case of an act of judgment that refers an ideal content to a reality beyond the act.  Peacocke is thus presenting the essence of Bradley’s position in an up-to-date form.)
• Sprigge, T.L.S., 1993, James and Bradley.  Chicago and La Salle, Illinois: Open Court.  Part II.  Chapters 2 and 3.
• Wollheim, R., 1959, F. H. Bradley. Harmondsworth: Penguin Books.

Author Information

D. L. C. Maclachlan
Email: lorne.maclachlan@gmail.com
Queen’s University
Canada