Epistemic Modality

Epistemic modality is the kind of necessity and possibility that is determined by epistemic constraints. A modal claim is a claim about how things could be or must be given some constraints, such as the rules of logic (logical modality), moral obligations (deontic modality), or the laws of nature (nomic modality). A modal claim is epistemic when these constraints are epistemic in nature, meaning roughly that they are related to knowledge, justification, or rationality. An epistemic possibility is something that may be true, given the relevant epistemic constraints (for example, “Given what we know about the weather, it might rain tomorrow”), while an epistemic necessity is something that must be true given the relevant epistemic constraints (for example, “I don’t see Julie’s car in the parking lot, so she must have gone home”).

The epistemic modal status of a proposition is determined by some body of information, such as an individual or group’s knowledge, a set of data, or the available evidence. A proposition that is not ruled out or eliminated by the information is epistemically possible, whereas a proposition that is in some sense guaranteed by the information is epistemically necessary. As an analogy, consider a detective investigating a crime. Initially, there is little evidence, and so there are many suspects. As more evidence is acquired, suspects are gradually ruled out—it could not have been the butler, since he was in the gazebo at the time of the crime—until only one remains, who must be guilty. Similarly, an epistemic agent may start with limited evidence that leaves open many epistemic possibilities. As the agent acquires more evidence, various possibilities are ruled out until some propositions are epistemically necessary and so must be true.

This article presents the distinctive features of epistemic modality and surveys different answers to the following questions about epistemic modality:

(1) Whose information determines the modal status of a proposition?
(2) How does information determine the modal status of a proposition?
(3) How is epistemic modality related to knowledge?

It concludes with a discussion of alternatives to the standard semantics for epistemic modal language.

Table of Contents

1. Epistemic Modality and Other Modalities
   1. Modal Puzzles
2. Whose Information Determines the Epistemic Modal Status of a Proposition?
   1. Context-Dependence
   2. Relativism
3. How Does Information Determine the Epistemic Modal Status of a Proposition?
   1. Negation
   2. Entailment
   3. Probability
   4. Dismissing
4. How is Epistemic Modality Related to Knowledge?
   1. Knowledge as the Relevant Information
   2. Epistemic Modality and Knowledge
   3. Concessive Knowledge Attributions
5. Alternatives to the Standard View of Epistemic Modals
   1. Embedded Epistemic Modals
   2. Hedging
   3. Other Views of Epistemic Modals
6. References and Further Reading

1. Epistemic Modality and Other Modalities

An epistemic modal is an epistemic use of a modal term, such as “might”, “necessarily”, or “possible”. On the standard view of epistemic modals, sentences in which these modals are the main operator are used to make epistemic modal claims that attribute an epistemic modal status, either possibility or necessity, to a proposition. For example, (1)-(8) can all be used to make epistemic modal claims:

(1) Maybe it will rain tomorrow.

(2) Terry may not do well on the test.

(3) Perhaps my grandmother is in Venezuela.

(4) The special theory of relativity might be true, and it might be false.

(5) Aristotle might not have been a philosopher.

(6) Given the angle of the blow, the killer must have been over six feet tall.

(7) Sam must be on her way by now.

(8) For all I know, there is no solution.

On this standard view, (1)-(5) can be used to attribute epistemic possibility using the different epistemic modals “maybe”, “may”, “perhaps”, and “might”. (1), for example, attributes epistemic possibility to the proposition that it will rain tomorrow, while (4) attributes epistemic possibility both to the proposition that the special theory of relativity is true and to its negation. (6) and (7), on the other hand, use the epistemic modal “must” to attribute epistemic necessity to the propositions that the killer was over six feet tall and that Sam is on her way, respectively. (8) is also naturally read as expressing an epistemic modal claim attributing epistemic possibility to the proposition that there is no solution, even though no modal term is explicitly used.

The distinguishing characteristic of epistemic modal claims is that their truth is determined by epistemic factors. The epistemic modal status of a proposition is determined by some body of information, and not by logical, metaphysical, or scientific laws. An epistemic possibility is not, for example, some way the world could have been, given the actual laws of physics. Instead, it is a way the world might yet be, given some body of information, such as what we currently know. So, (4), if read as a claim about epistemic possibility, does not assert that the truth and falsehood of the special theory of relativity are both compatible with the laws of physics. It says only that both the truth and falsehood of the theory are individually compatible with some information, such as what the speaker knows. Similarly, an epistemic necessity is not some way the world had to be, given the constraints of logic. Instead, it is a way the world must in fact be, given, for example, what we have discovered about it. So, an utterance of (7) does not assert that some logical contradiction or metaphysical impossibility follows from the assumption that Sam is not on her way. It says only that, given some information, such as what we know about Sam’s schedule, she must in fact be on her way.

As a result, epistemic modal claims are about the actual world in a way that some other modal claims are not. An epistemic possibility is not an alternative way the world might have been had things gone differently, but a way the world might yet turn out to be given the relevant information. (5), if read as expressing metaphysical possibility, is true just in case there is some metaphysically possible world in which Aristotle is not a philosopher. So, it is about the various alternative ways that the world could have been, asserting that at least one of them includes Aristotle not being a philosopher. But (5) is ambiguous and could also be used to make a claim about epistemic possibility: that Aristotle not being a philosopher in this world is left open by the relevant information. If, for example, there were not enough information to determine whether Aristotle had ever done any philosophy in the actual world, it would be epistemically possible that Aristotle was not a philosopher. Unlike the metaphysical possibility claim, this claim is not about an alternative way that the world could have been, but instead about how the past might turn out to have actually been.

Similarly, an epistemic necessity is a way the world must in fact be, but not a way the world had to be— that is, an epistemic necessity might very well not be a metaphysical or logical necessity (and vice versa). The claim that it is metaphysically necessary that 2+2=4, for example, is true just in case there are no metaphysically possible worlds in which the sum of 2 and 2 is something other than 4. So, this claim asserts that, in all possible ways the world could have been, 2+2=4. On the other hand, an epistemic necessity claim made using (6) is true just in case the killer being over six feet tall is in some sense guaranteed by the angle of the blow. This claim is therefore not about how things had to be in all of the various ways the world could have been, but merely about how things must be given our information about how the world in fact is.

Another feature that distinguishes epistemic modality from other kinds of modality is that, because the epistemic modal status of a proposition is determined by epistemic constraints, it can vary over time and between subjects. So, I may truly utter (1) today, but having seen no rain by the end of the day tomorrow, I would have different information and could no longer truly say that rain on that day is possible. Similarly, not knowing my grandmother’s travel itinerary, I could truly say (3), but my cousin who has just found out that our grandmother’s trip to Venezuela was cancelled could not. As a result, it is common to say that a proposition is epistemically possible or necessary for some person or group (for example, “it was possible for Aristotle that the Earth was at the center of our solar system”), meaning it is possible or necessary on that person or group’s information. In contrast, logical, metaphysical, and nomic modalities do not vary across time and between subjects.

a. Modal Puzzles

Distinguishing epistemic modality from other modalities is a key step in solving some philosophical puzzles. Consider Goldbach’s conjecture:

(GC) Every even integer greater than 2 is the sum of two primes.

There is a sense in which (GCT) and (GCF) both seem true

(GCT) It is possible that Goldbach’s conjecture is true.

(GCF) It is possible that Goldbach’s conjecture is false.

But the truth value of Goldbach’s conjecture, like other mathematical truths, is often considered as being of necessity—it is either necessarily false or necessarily true. So, if (GCT) and (GCF) are expressions of mathematical possibility, they generate a contradiction. If Goldbach’s conjecture is possibly true, then it is necessarily true, and if it is possibly false, then it is necessarily false. From (GCT) and (GCF), then, it would follow that Goldbach’s conjecture is both necessarily true and necessarily false.

This result can be avoided by distinguishing mathematical possibility from epistemic possibility. Although (GCT) and (GCF) cannot both be true if they are read as claims about mathematical possibility, they can both be true when read as claims about epistemic possibility. According to one view of epistemic possibility, for example, because we do not yet know whether Goldbach’s conjecture is true or false, both options are epistemically possible for us. However, to avoid contradiction, this must not entail that they are both mathematically possible.

A puzzle involving co-referring names can similarly be solved by appeal to epistemic possibility. According to some views of names (for example, Kripke (1972)), the proposition “Hesperus is identical to Phosphorus” expresses a metaphysically necessary truth, since “Hesperus” and “Phosphorous” are both names for the planet Venus. Nevertheless, a person who has no reason to think that that “Hesperus” and “Phosphorous” refer to the same thing could truly say “it is possible that Hesperus is not identical to Phosphorous”. But if it is (metaphysically) necessarily true that Hesperus is identical to Phosphorous, then it cannot be (metaphysically) possible that Hesperus is not identical to Phosphorous. The contradiction can be avoided by understanding “it is possible Hesperus is not identical to Phosphorous” as a statement of epistemic, rather than metaphysical, possibility. It is epistemically possible, relative to the information of someone who does not know what these names refer to, that Hesperus is not identical to Phosphorous, even though it is not metaphysically possible. (See also Modal Illusions)

These solutions to these puzzles demonstrate two ways in which epistemic possibility is distinct from other kinds of possibility. It is broader in the sense that a logical, mathematical or metaphysical impossibility may be epistemically possible, as in the case of Goldbach’s conjecture or its negation (whichever is false). Similarly, a proposition can be epistemically necessary (for some subject), but not metaphysically, mathematically, or logically necessary. It is not metaphysically necessary that Descartes existed—he could have failed to exist. Nevertheless, it was epistemically necessary for Descartes that he existed—given his information, he must have existed. Epistemic possibility is also narrower in the sense that many logical, mathematical and metaphysical possibilities, such as that no human beings ever existed, are not epistemic possibilities. Epistemic necessity, too, is narrower, in that many logical, mathematical and metaphysical necessities are not epistemically necessary, such as yet-unproven theorems of logic. Because of these differences, epistemic modality “cuts across” logical, mathematical and metaphysical modalities, with the result that facts about epistemic modality cannot be inferred from facts about these other modalities, and vice versa.

2. Whose Information Determines the Epistemic Modal Status of a Proposition?

The epistemic modal status of a proposition is determined by some body of information, but it is not always specified which information is relevant. Phrases like “given the evidence presented today…”, “in view of the information we have…”, and “for all I know…” often indicate the relevant information for a particular epistemic modal claim. However, many sentences used to make epistemic modal claims lack this kind of clear indicator. Claim (1), for example, does not specify for whom or on which body of information it is possible that it will rain tomorrow. Since people have different information about the weather, the proposition that it will rain tomorrow may be possible on the information possessed by some people, but not on the information possessed by others. As a result, a complete theory of epistemic modal claims must have some mechanism for determining whose information is relevant in determining their truth.

a. Context-Dependence

According to some theories, the truth of an epistemic modal claim varies with features of the context in which it is made. Call these “context-dependent theories” of epistemic modal claims. On these views, facts about the context of assertion—that is, the situation in which the epistemic modal claim is spoken, written, or otherwise conveyed—affect the truth of the claim. The simplest kind of context-dependent theory is one in which the relevant information is the information possessed by the speaker:

(Speaker)

“It might be that p” is true as tokened by the speaker S at time t if and only if p is epistemically possible on the information possessed by S at t.

According to (Speaker), whether an epistemic possibility claim expressed by “it might be that p” is true is determined by whether p is epistemically possible on the information possessed by the person who asserts that claim. Thus, the feature of the context that is relevant to determining the claim’s truth value is the information possessed by the speaker. If Paul says, for example, “it might be that God exists”, his claim is true just in case it is epistemically possible for Paul (that is, on the information that he possesses), at the time of his speaking, that God exists.

However, (Speaker) gives counterintuitive results in dialogues about epistemic modality. Suppose, for example, that Katie and Julia are discussing Laura’s whereabouts. Julia knows that Laura left on a flight for Hungary this morning, but Katie does not know that Laura has left. They then have the following discussion:

Katie: Laura might be in the living room.

Julia: No. She can’t be in the living room, because she left for Hungary this morning.

Katie: Oops. I guess I was wrong.

The problem for (Speaker) is that it is epistemically possible on Katie’s information at the beginning of the dialogue that Laura is in the living room. So, according to (Speaker), she speaks truly when she says “Laura might be in the living room”. To some, this seems false—since Julia knows that Laura is on her way to Hungary, Katie’s claim that she might be in the living room cannot be true. Furthermore, Katie seems right to correct herself at the end of the dialogue, but if (Speaker) is true, then this is a mistake. Even though Laura being in the living room is not possible on the information Katie has after talking to Julia, it was possible on her original information at the time that she spoke, which is all that is necessary to make her claim true, according to (Speaker

This problem can be avoided by expanding the relevant information to include information possessed by people other than the speaker, as in:

(Audience)

“It might be that p” is true as tokened by the subject S at time t if and only if p is epistemically possible on the combined information possessed by S and S’s audience at t.

On this view, because Julia is Katie’s audience, her information is also used in determining whether Katie’s claim is true. Since Julia knows that Laura is on her way to Hungary, it is not possible on her information that Laura is in the living room, making Katie’s initial epistemic possibility claim false and her later self-correction warranted.

In some cases, though, the epistemic modal status of a proposition is evaluated relative to the information of some party other than the speaker or its audience. One appropriate response to the question “Is it true that the universe might continue expanding forever?”, for example, is “I don’t know; only a scientist would know if that’s possible.”. But if it is just the information of the speaker and its audience that determines the truth of epistemic possibility claims, this response is bizarre. All it would take to know whether the universe might continue expanding forever is to check the information possessed by those two parties. Here, though, it seems that the possibility of the universe’s continued expansion is being evaluated relative to the information possessed by the scientific community, which the speaker does not have access to. This suggests that, in some contexts, the relevant information is not the information of the speaker or its audience, but the information possessed by the members of some other community. Incorporating this idea gives the following kind of principle:

(Community)

“It might be that p” is true as tokened by the subject S at time t if and only if p is epistemically possible on the information possessed by the members of the relevant community at t.

This view is still context-dependent, as which community is relevant is determined by contextual factors, such as the topic and purpose of the conversation. Note that the relevant community may often include just the speaker or just the speaker and its audience (as in Katie and Julia’s case). (Community) simply allows that in some contexts the information of the scientific community, for example, determines the truth of the epistemic modal claim.

Other examples suggest that even (Community) is insufficiently flexible to account for all epistemic modal claims, as they are sometimes evaluated relative to information that no one actually possesses. The classic example of this comes from Hacking (1967):

Imagine a salvage crew searching for a ship that sank a long time ago. The mate of the salvage ship works from an old log, makes some mistakes in his calculations, and concludes that the wreck may be in a certain bay. It is possible, he says, that the hulk is in these waters. No one knows anything to the contrary. But in fact, as it turns out later, it simply was not possible for the vessel to be in that bay; more careful examination of the log shows that the boat must have gone down at least thirty miles further south. The mate said something false… but the falsehood did not arise from what anyone actually knew at the time.

This kind of case leads some to include not only the information possessed by the relevant community, but also information that members of that community could acquire through investigation. No one in any community has information that rules out that the hulk is in the bay, so that cannot be why the mate’s claim is false. There is, however, an investigation the mate (or any member of the community) could make, a more careful examination of the log, that would yield information that rules out this possibility. If this is why the mate’s claim is false, then the truth of epistemic modal claims must be determined not only by the information possessed by the relevant community, but also by information that is in some way available to that community. Not just any way of gaining information can count, though, as for almost any false proposition, there will be some possible way of acquiring information that rules it out. Since many false propositions are epistemically possible, then, there must be some restriction on which kinds of investigations matter. There are many options for formulating this restriction, but one option is that it is also determined by context:

(Investigation)	“It might be that p” is true as tokened by the subject S at time t if and only if:
	(i) p is epistemically possible on the information possessed by the members of the relevant community at t, and
	(ii) there is no relevant way for the members of that community to acquire information on which p is not epistemically possible.

According to (Investigation), which ways of acquiring information can affect the truth of epistemic modal claims is determined by features of the context in just the same way that the community is. Depending on the speaker’s background information, motivations, and so forth, different ways of acquiring information will be relevant. Since the mate has just checked the log and knows that he is basing his judgment on the data in the log, checking the log is a relevant way of acquiring information, and so his claim is false. By contrast, a student could truly say during an exam “the answer might be “Gettier”, but I’m not sure”. Although there are ways, such as reading through the textbook, for the student to acquire information that rules out that answer, none of those ways is relevant in the context of an exam. (Investigation) is thus in principle able to account for cases where information that no one has seems to determine the truth of epistemic modal claims.

b. Relativism

 According to relativist theories of epistemic modal claims, these claims are true relative to the context in which they are evaluated, rather than to the context in which they are asserted. Whereas context-dependent theories allow for different tokens of the same type of epistemic claim to have different truth values, these relativist views allow for the same token of some epistemic claim to have different truth values when evaluated in different contexts. The primary motivation for this kind of view is that a single token of an epistemic modal claim can be judged true in one context but false in another, and both judgments can seem correct. This happens in eavesdropping cases like the following:

Mara, Ian, and Eliza are playing a game of hide-and-seek. Mara is hiding in the closet while Ian and Eliza are searching for her. Ian and Eliza are discussing where Mara might be, and Ian says “She might be in the kitchen, since we haven’t checked there yet”. Listening from the closet, though, Mara knows that Ian is wrong—she is most definitely not in the kitchen.

The puzzle is that Ian’s reasoning seems perfectly good; any room which they have not checked yet is a room in which Mara might be hiding. Assuming the relevant community does not include Mara, no one in the relevant community has information that rules out that Mara is in the kitchen, and so it is epistemically possible on the community’s information that she is in the kitchen. However, Mara’s assessment that Ian is wrong also seems correct. She could not truthfully say “I know I am not in the kitchen, but Ian is right when he says that I might be in the kitchen”. So, the very same token of “She might be in the kitchen” seems true when evaluated by Ian and Eliza, but false when evaluated by Mara.

To accommodate this sort of intuition, relativists propose that epistemic modal claims are true only relative to the context in which they are assessed, resulting in a view like the following:

(Relativism)

“It might be that p” is true as tokened by the subject S at time t1 and assessed by the agent A at time t2 if and only if p is epistemically possible on the information possessed by A at t2.

According to (Relativism), Ian’s claim that Mara might be in the kitchen is true when assessed by Ian and Eliza, since it is epistemically possible on their information that she is hiding in the kitchen. However, it is not true when assessed by Mara, since it is not epistemically possible on her information that she is in the kitchen; she knows full well that she is in the closet. On this kind of view, the token has no fixed truth value based on the context in which it is asserted; it has a truth value only relative to the context in which it is being assessed. On (Relativism), the feature of the context of assessment that determines this truth value is the information possessed by the person doing the assessing, but other relativist views may include other features such as the assessor’s intentions, the purpose of the assessment, information the assessor could easily obtain, and so forth.

One way of addressing this puzzle within the confines of a context-dependent theory is to include Mara in the relevant community, such that her knowledge that she is not in the kitchen makes Ian’s claim false, regardless of what Ian and Eliza know. This would allow the proponent of a context-dependent theory to say that Ian’s claim is strictly false, but still conversationally appropriate, as he does not know about the information that makes it false. Generalizing this strategy gives an implausible result, however, as there would be equally good reasons to include in the relevant community anyone who will ever consider a claim of epistemic possibility. As a result, any claim of the form “it might be that p”, where p will at some point be discovered by someone to be false, is false. If we know this, then it is almost always inappropriate to assert that p might be true, since we know that if p is ever discovered to be false, then our assertion will have been false. So, if epistemic possibility claims are commonly appropriate to assert, as they seem to be, there is a reason to doubt the context-dependent account of this case.

3. How Does Information Determine the Epistemic Modal Status of a Proposition?

Theories of epistemic modality also differ in how a proposition must be related to the relevant information in order to have a given epistemic modal status. Even if it is agreed that a proposition is epistemically possible for a subject S just in case it is not ruled out by what S knows, for example, there remains the question of what it takes for S’s knowledge to rule out a proposition.

a. Negation

 The simplest view of this relation is that a proposition is possible on a body of information just in case the information does not include the negation of that proposition. If the relevant information is a subject’s knowledge, for example, this yields:

(Negation)

p is epistemically possible for a subject S if and only if S does not know that not-p.

So, if Bozo knows that he is at the circus, then it is not epistemically possible for him that he is not at the circus, whereas if he does not know that the square root of 289 is 17, then it is possible for him that it is not.

A difficulty for this sort of view involves a proposition that is intuitively ruled out by what someone knows, even though that person does not explicitly know the proposition’s negation. Suppose, for example, that Holmes knows that Adler has stolen his pipe. Holmes is perfectly capable of deducing from this that someone stole his pipe, but he has not bothered to do so. So, Holmes has not formed the belief that someone stole his pipe. As a result, he does not know that someone stole the pipe. According to (Negation), then, it is still epistemically possible for Holmes that no one stole the pipe (that is, that it is not the case that someone stole the pipe), even though it is not epistemically possible for Holmes that Adler did not steal the pipe. This is problematic, as knowing that Adler stole the pipe seems sufficient to rule out that no one stole the pipe, as the former obviously entails the falsehood of the latter. So, S’s not knowing not-p is not sufficient for p to be epistemically possible for S.

b. Entailment

To accommodate this kind of case, some theories require only that the information include something that entails not-p, such as:

(Entailment)

p is epistemically possible for a subject S if and only if nothing that S knows entails not-p.

This resolves the problem in the Holmes case, as Holmes knows something (that Adler stole the pipe) which entails that someone stole the pipe. So, it is not epistemically possible for Holmes that no one stole the pipe, regardless of whether Holmes has formed the belief that someone stole the pipe.

However, views like (Entailment) face problems involving logically and metaphysically necessary propositions. On the assumption that logically and metaphysically necessary propositions are entailed by any body of information, their negations will be epistemically impossible for any subject on this kind of view. If Goldbach’s conjecture is false, for example, then any subject’s knowledge entails the negation of Goldbach’s conjecture. Nevertheless, it is epistemically possible for many subjects that Goldbach’s conjecture is true. So, S not knowing anything that entails not-p cannot be necessary for p to be epistemically possible for S.”

Another potential problem is that requiring the entailment of not-p to rule out p seems to result in too many epistemic possibilities. For example, if the detective knows that fingerprints matching the butler’s were found on the gun that killed the victim, that powder burns were found on the butler’s hands, that reliable witnesses testified that the butler had the only key to the room where the body was found, and that there is surveillance footage that shows the butler committing the murder, this would still be insufficient to rule out the butler’s innocence according to (Entailment), since none of these facts properly entail that the butler is guilty. Similarly, if the relevant information is not a subject’s knowledge but instead her foundational beliefs and/or experiences, then very few propositions will not be epistemically possible for a given subject. With the exception of necessary truths and propositions about my own mental states, none of the propositions I believe is entailed by my experiences or foundational beliefs (for more, see Fallibilism). As a result, if this information must entail not-p in order to rule out p as an epistemic possibility, nearly all contingent propositions will be epistemically possible for every subject. Because of this, any subject could truly assert “given my evidence, I might be standing on the moon right now”, which is a prima facie problem for this kind of view.

c. Probability

One way of weakening the conditions necessary to rule out a proposition is to analyze epistemic possibility in terms of probability:

(Probability)

p is epistemically possible for a subject S if and only if the probability of p given what S knows is greater than or equal to x, where x is some threshold of probability between 0 and 1.

As long as x is greater than 0, this kind of view allows for p to be ruled out even when S’s knowledge does not entail not-p. If the probability of p given S’s knowledge is greater than 0 but less than x, there is still some chance (given what S knows) that p is true, but it does not follow that p is epistemically possible for S. Note, however, that, for any understanding of probability that obeys the Kolmogorov Axioms, (Probability) will face the same problem with necessary falsehoods that (Entailment) does. On any such understanding, the probability of a logically necessary falsehood is 0, and so no logically and metaphysically necessary falsehoods can be epistemically possible.

d. Dismissing

More complex theories about the “ruling-out relation” include Huemer’s (2007) proposal, which requires, among other things, that S have justification adequate for dismissing p in order for S to rule out p. “Dismissing” is meant to capture particularly strong disbelief in p or “disbelieving [p] and regarding the question as settled” (p. 132). Since, according to Huemer, the degree of justification adequate for dismissing a proposition varies with context, an epistemic possibility claim can be true in one context, but false in another. So, on this view, epistemic modal claims are context-sensitive even when the relevant information is specified, in a way that parallels the context-sensitivity of “know” argued for by epistemic contextualists. For example, on this kind of contextualist view, standards for dismissing may be low in ordinary contexts, but high when confronted with a skeptic. If so, then a subject can truly assert “it is not the case that I might be the victim of an evil demon” in an ordinary context, and also truly assert “I might be the victim of an evil demon” when confronted with a skeptic.

4. How is Epistemic Modality Related to Knowledge?

Since the modality under discussion is epistemic, it is natural to suppose that it is closely related to knowledge. This would account for the common use of “for all I know” and “for all anyone knows” to attribute epistemic possibility, as well as providing a straightforward explanation of what is epistemic about epistemic modality. It would also account for the apparent relevance of what might and must be true to what we know. There are, however, several different accounts of this relation.

a. Knowledge as the Relevant Information

One proposal is that knowledge is the relevant type of information that determines the epistemic modal status of a proposition. Whatever the correct theory of the ruling out relation, then, the following would be true:

p is epistemically possible for a subject S if and only if p is not ruled out by what S knows.

However, there are at least two problems with this sort of view. First, a subject may fail to know something for reasons that are intuitively irrelevant to the modal status of the proposition in question. Let q be a proposition such that if S knew q, then S’s knowledge would rule out p, and suppose that S satisfies every condition for knowledge of q except that S does not believe q. This may be because S lacks a concept required to believe q, has a psychological flaw that prevents her from believing q, or simply has not gotten around to forming the belief that q. These kinds of reasons for not believing q do not seem to affect what is epistemically possible for S, and yet if epistemic possibility is understood in terms of knowledge, they do.

The second problem is that epistemic modal claims are sometimes assessed relative to a body of information that no one actually knows. A computer hard drive, for example, may contain a tremendous amount of data, more than anyone could possibly know. Referencing such a drive, a person could assert “given the information on this drive, system X might contain a planet that would support life”. This is an epistemic modal claim that may be true or false, but its truth value cannot be determined by what anyone knows, since no one knows all of the data on the drive. As a result, the epistemic modal status of a proposition must at least sometimes be determined by a type of information other than knowledge.

An alternative proposal is that epistemic modality is determined by evidence. What this view amounts to depends on one’s theory of evidence. Evidence may include publicly available evidence, such as the data on a drive, the records in a log, or the results of an experiment. Evidence may also be understood as a subject’s personal evidence, consisting of experiences and other mental states (see Evidentialism).

b. Epistemic Modality and Knowledge

 Whether or not knowledge is the information that determines epistemic modality, many epistemological views connect knowledge to epistemic modality. In particular, ruling out the epistemic possibility that not-p is claimed by many to be a necessary condition for knowing that p:

(K1)	S knows that p only if not-p is not epistemically possible for S.

Others also accept the potentially stronger claim that knowledge requires ruling out the epistemic possibility of any proposition incompatible with p:

(K2)	S knows that p only if there is no q such that:
	(i) q entails not-p, and
	(ii) q is epistemically possible for S.

One motivation for this kind of connection between epistemic possibility and knowledge is the idea that epistemic necessity just is knowledge, such that p is epistemically necessary for S just in case S knows that p. On the assumption that epistemic necessity and possibility are duals, in the sense that a proposition is epistemically necessary just in case its negation is not epistemically possible, and vice versa (see Modal Logic), this would entail (K1).

A second motivation is the intuitive idea that knowledge requires the exhaustion of alternative possibilities, that in order to know that p, one must perform a thorough enough investigation to exclude any alternatives to p. For a detective to know that the butler is guilty, for example, she must rule out all of the other suspects. In doing so, she would rule out every possibility in which the butler was not guilty, thereby satisfying the consequent of (K2). If knowledge requires this kind of elimination of alternatives, then, there is good reason to accept (K2).

The main reason to doubt principles like (K1) and (K2) is their apparent inconsistency with fallibilism about knowledge, the view that some or all of our knowledge has inconclusive justification. If our justification for p is inconclusive, then there is some chance, given that justification, that not-p is true. But this seems to commit us to saying that not-p might be true and is therefore epistemically possible. So, if (K1) is true, then we do not know p after all. Since conclusive justification for our beliefs is very rare, applying this reasoning generally has the implausibly skeptical consequence that we have very little knowledge of the world.

c. Concessive Knowledge Attributions

A related issue is the apparent incoherence of Concessive Knowledge Attributions (“CKAs”) in which a subject claims to know something while admitting the (epistemic) possibility of error. (9), for example, sounds odd:

(9) I know that I own a cat, but I might not own a cat.

Furthermore, (9) seems to be in some way self-defeating—admitting the epistemic possibility that the speaker does not own a cat seems like an admission that she does not in fact know that she owns a cat. (10) has similar problems:

(10) I know that I own a cat, but I might not own any animals.

As long as the speaker knows that all cats are animals, asserting (10) seems problematic in roughly the same way as asserting (9) does. The second conjunct seems to commit the speaker to denying the first. An account of the relationship between epistemic possibility and knowledge must therefore give some explanation of the apparent tension in CKAs like (9) and (10).

The most straightforward account of the oddness of CKAs is that they are self-contradictory and therefore false. If (K1) is true, then sentences of the form “S knows that p” and “not-p is epistemically possible for S” are mutually inconsistent. On this kind of view, (9) seems odd and self-defeating because its conjuncts are inconsistent with each other—if the speaker knows that he owns a cat, then it is not epistemically possible for him that he does not own a cat. If (K2) is true, then sentences of the form “S knows that p” and “q is epistemically possible for S” (where q entails not-p) are also mutually inconsistent. So, on this kind of view (10) seems odd and self-defeating for just the same reason. If the speaker knows that she owns a cat, then according to (K2) no proposition that entails that she does not own a cat is epistemically possible for her. Since not owning an animal entails not owning a cat, then, it cannot be epistemically possible for the speaker that she does not own any animals.

On Lewis’s (1996) account, CKAs are not strictly self-contradictory, but they can never be truly asserted. For Lewis, “S knows that p” is true just in case S’s evidence rules out all not-p possibilities that are not properly ignored. Which possibilities are properly ignored varies with the conversational context, such that “S knows that p” may be true in one context, but false in another in which fewer propositions are properly ignored. As a result, there may be contexts in which “S knows that p” and “it might be that q” would be true, even though q entails not-p, so long as q is one of the not-p possibilities that is properly ignored in that context. So, strictly speaking, these sentences are not mutually inconsistent.

However, there are rules that govern when a possibility is properly ignored in a context, one of which is the Rule of Attention. This rule entails that any not-p possibility that is explicitly mentioned is not properly ignored, since it is not ignored at all. Because of this, conjunctions of the form “S knows that p, but it might be that q”, where q is a not-p possibility, cannot be truly asserted. Mentioning the not-p possibility q prevents it from being properly ignored. So, if q is not ruled out by S’s evidence, then “S knows that p” is false. This accounts for the tension in (9) and (10), as mentioning the epistemic possibilities that the speaker does not own a cat or does not own any animals is sufficient to prevent them from being properly ignored. This makes the speaker’s claim that she knows she owns a cat false, which is why these CKAs seem self-defeating, even though they are not strictly inconsistent.

Other views, such as that of Dougherty & Rysiew (2009), hold that CKAs are often true, but conversationally inappropriate to assert. On their view, p is epistemically possible for a subject just in case the subject’s evidence (consisting of her mental states) does not entail not-p. So, nearly all contingent propositions are epistemically possible. Because of this, mentioning that a contingent proposition is epistemically possible would be a strange thing to do in most conversations, akin to noting the obvious truth that there is a metaphysical possibility that one’s beliefs are false. As a result, on this view, asserting that a proposition is epistemically possible pragmatically implicates something more, such as that one has some compelling reason for taking seriously the possibility that not-p, and so one is not confident that p. As a result, CKAs like (9) and (10) are often true, as they assert that the speaker knows that p and does not have entailing evidence for p. However, they are conversationally inappropriate to assert. Unless the speaker has some good reason to suppose that she does not own a cat, it is inappropriate to assert that she might not. However, if she does have such a reason, then she should not say that she knows that she owns a cat, because doing so implicates confidence in and adequate evidence for the proposition that she owns a cat which are incompatible with having that kind of reason.

5. Alternatives to the Standard View of Epistemic Modals

The standard view of epistemic modals introduced in section 1 holds that epistemic modals like “might” and “must” are used to express epistemic modal claims attributing either epistemic possibility or epistemic necessity to propositions. This standard view is committed to two important theses, each of which has been challenged.

First, on the standard view, epistemic modals affect the semantic content of sentences. So, a sentence of the form “it might be that p” differs in its semantic content from simply “p”. For example, an utterance of proposition (2), “Terry may not do well on the test”, does not simply express the proposition that Terry will not do well on the test. Instead, it expresses the epistemic modal claim that the proposition that Terry will do well on the test is epistemically possible on the relevant information. This difference in meaning yields a difference in truth conditions, such that it is possible for someone to truly assert (2) even if Terry will in fact do well on the test (if, for example, the speaker does not know whether Terry will do well).

Second, sentences containing epistemic modals typically serve to describe the world, in the sense that they describe some proposition as having some particular modal status. Thus, whatever effect epistemic modals have on the meaning of sentences, they typically result in the expression of a descriptive claim about the world that can be evaluated for truth.

a. Embedded Epistemic Modals

The most significant challenge to the standard view is that epistemic modal sentences behave strangely when embedded in other sentences, which the standard view does not predict. As Yalcin (2007) first pointed out, conjunctions including epistemic modals yield unusual results when embedded in other kinds of sentences. Consider a case in which it is raining outside, but you have not looked out of the window. For you, then, it is epistemically possible that it is not raining, even though it is in fact raining. Nevertheless, the conjunction of “it is raining” and “it might not be raining” sounds odd when embedded in certain kinds of sentences. For example, the imperative sentence (11) sounds odd:

(11) Suppose that it is raining and it might not be raining.

(11) seems to give a command that is in some way defective; the conjunction in question cannot be coherently supposed. However, this seemingly cannot be because the conjuncts “it is raining” and “it might not be raining” are logically inconsistent. If they were, then “it might not be raining” would entail “it is not raining”, but the mere epistemic possibility that it is not raining seemingly cannot entail that it is in fact not raining. So, on the standard view, there is no obvious reason that (11) should be defective, as it simply asks you to suppose that two compatible claims are both true.

Similarly, (12) sounds odd:

(12) If it is raining and it might not be raining, then it is raining.

This oddness is unexpected, since, given the usual semantics for conditionals and the standard view of epistemic modals, (12) should be trivially true. Any material conditional of the form “If A and B, then A” should be obviously true, and yet the truth value of (12) is not obvious. This is not because (12) seems false, but because there seems to be something wrong with the antecedent of (12). On the standard view, though, there is no obvious reason that this should be the case. Each conjunct expresses a claim about the world, and whatever claim is expressed by the second conjunct, the consequent clearly follows from the first conjunct alone. In response to these puzzles, Yalcin (2007) develops a semantics according to which sentences like “it is raining and it might not be raining” really are strictly contradictory, but this is not the only way to account for the oddness of sentences like (11) and (12).

b. Hedging

An alternative to the standard view is that the modals of epistemic possibility (“may”, “might”, “perhaps”, etc.) are used to “hedge” or express reduced confidence about the expressed proposition, rather than to attribute any modal status. As Coates (1983 131) describes this kind of view: “MAY and MIGHT are the modals of Epistemic Possibility, expressing the speaker’s lack of confidence in the proposition expressed” (p. ?). On this kind of view, epistemic modals do not affect the semantic content of a sentence but are instead used to indicate the speaker’s uncertainty about the truth of that content. For example, on Schnieder’s (2010) view, (2) and (2¢) have the same semantic content:

(2) Terry may not do well on the test.

(2′) Terry will not do well on the test.

However, while a speaker who utters (2′) thereby asserts that Terry will not do well on the test, a speaker who utters (2) makes no assertion at all but instead engages in a different kind of speech act that presents that speaker as being uncertain about the proposition that Terry will not do well on the test. Thus, though the two sentences have the same semantic content, the epistemic modal in (2) results in an expression of the speaker’s uncertainty, rather than in an epistemic modal claim that describes a proposition as having some modal status. Views of this kind are therefore incompatible with both theses of the standard view, since epistemic modals do not affect the semantic content of a sentence, and sentences like (2) are not used to describe the world.

Hedging views can offer some account of the oddness of embedded epistemic modals, since on these views the speaker is using “may” or “might” to express uncertainty in situations in which it is inappropriate to do so. If, for example, it is only appropriate to suppose something that could be asserted, then (11) should sound odd, since “it might be raining” cannot be used to make an assertion. Thus, they seem to have some advantage over the standard view.

However, a significant objection to the underlying idea that epistemic modals do not affect semantic content, raised by Papafragou (2006), is that adding an epistemic modal to a sentence seems to change its truth conditions in many ordinary cases. Suppose, for example, that my grandmother is on vacation in South America, and I cannot recall her exact itinerary. On a hedging view, (3) and (3¢) have the same semantic content, and thus the same truth conditions:

(3) My grandmother might be in Venezuela.

(3′) My grandmother is in Venezuela.

If my grandmother is in fact in Brazil, then (3′) is false. So, if epistemic modals do not affect truth conditions, then (3) must also be false. But since I cannot remember her itinerary, I seem to speak truly when I utter (3). This difference in truth values requires a difference in semantic content, contrary to what hedging views predict. Similarly, if epistemic modals do not affect semantic content, then the proposition expressed by claim (4) (that is, “the special theory of relativity might be true, and it might be false”) would be a contradiction.

This raises two problems. First, intuitively, a speaker could use (4) to assert something true (if, for example, she did not know whether the special theory of relativity was true or false). Second, if (4) is not used to assert anything but instead used to express the speaker’s uncertainty about the semantic content of the sentence, then an utterance of (4) would express uncertainty about the truth value of a contradiction. But, at least in ordinary circumstances, that would be a strange epistemic state for a speaker to express.

Defenders of hedging views have options for responding to these objections, however. Perhaps, for example, my utterance of (3) seems appropriate when my grandmother is in Brazil not because it is true, but because it is sincere—I am presenting myself as being uncertain that my grandmother is not in Venezuela, and in fact I am uncertain of that proposition. This would explain why an utterance of (3) can be intuitively correct in some sense, even though the only proposition expressed in that utterance is false. And perhaps (4) is not an expression of uncertainty about a contradiction but instead a combination of two different speech acts: one expressing uncertainty that the special theory of relativity is true and another expressing uncertainty that it is false.

c. Other Views of Epistemic Modals

Another alternative to the standard view is to accept the first thesis that epistemic modals affect semantic content but deny the second thesis that they are used descriptively to attribute some epistemic modal status to a proposition. For example, a view of this kind is considered in Yalcin (2011): “To say that a proposition is possible, or that it might be the case, is to express the compatibility of the proposition with one’s state of mind, with the intention of engendering coordination on this property with one’s interlocutor” (p. 312). On this view, (3) and (3¢) do not have the same truth conditions, because (3) does not have truth conditions at all—it does not describe the world as being any particular way and so does not attribute any modal status to any proposition. Similarly, Willer’s (2013) dynamic semantics for epistemic modals does not assign truth conditions to epistemic modal claims but instead relations between information states, such that uttering (3) aims to change mere possibilities that are compatible with an agent’s evidence into “live” possibilities that the agent takes seriously in inquiry. On Swanson’s (2016) view, the content of an epistemic modal sentence is not a proposition but a constraint on credences, such that a speaker uttering (3) thereby advises their audience to adopt a set of credences that does not rule out or overlook the possibility that Terry will not do well on the test. On all of these views, epistemic modals affect the semantic content of the sentences in which they occur, but the resulting contents are not propositions with truth values. Thus, though they each handle embedded epistemic modals differently, none of these views are committed to the same seemingly implausible verdicts about sentences like (11) and (12) as the standard view.

6. References and Further Reading

• Barnett, D. 2009. Yalcin on ‘Might’. Mind 118: 771-75.
  • A proposed solution to the embedding problem for epistemic modals.
• Coates, J. 1983. The Semantics of Modal Auxiliaries. London: Croom Helm.
  • An account of the semantics of modals in English, including a discussion of hedging with epistemic modals.
• DeRose, K. 1991. Epistemic Possibilities. The Philosophical Review 100: 581-605.
  • An overview of context-dependent accounts of epistemic modals, and a defense of (Investigation).
• DeRose, K. 1998. Simple ‘Might’s, Indicative Possibilities and the Open Future. The Philosophical Quarterly 48: 67-82.
  • An argument that simple “might” and “possible” sentences are used to make epistemic modal claims.
• Dougherty, T. and P. Rysiew. 2009. Fallibilism, Epistemic Possibility, and Concessive Knowledge Attributions. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 78: 123-32.
  • Arguments for evidence being the relevant type of information, entailment being the relevant relation, and concessive knowledge attributions being typically true, but pragmatically inappropriate.
• Egan, A. 2007. Epistemic Modals, Relativism, and Assertion. Philosophical Studies 133: 1-22.
  • A defense of relativism about epistemic modals, as well as a discussion of an objection to relativism based on the role of assertions.
• Egan, A., J. Hawthorne, and B. Weatherson. 2005. Epistemic Modals in Context. In Contextualism in Philosophy, eds. G. Peter and P. Preyer. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 131-70
  • An extended discussion of contextualism and a defense of relativism.
• Hacking, I. 1967. Possibility. The Philosophical Review 76: 143-68.
  • On the salvage case as motivation for a view like (Investigation).
• Hawthorne, J. 2004. Knowledge and Lotteries. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • On epistemic possibility and its relation to knowledge.
• Hintikka, J. 1962. Knowledge and Belief: An Introduction to the Logic of the Two Notions. Ithaca: Cornell University Press.
  • Development of a logic of epistemic modality, using a knowledge-based account of epistemic possibility.
• Huemer, M. 2007. Epistemic Possibility. Synthese 156: 119-42.
  • Overview of problems for several different accounts of epistemic possibility, concluding in a defense of the dismissing view (section 3d).
• Kripke, S. 1972. Naming and Necessity. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
  • Distinguishes epistemic from metaphysical modality using the Hesperus/Phosphorous example.
• Lewis, D. 1996. Elusive Knowledge. Australasian Journal of Philosophy 74: 549-67.
  • Motivation for (K2), as well as Lewis’s account of CKAs.
• MacFarlane, J. 2011. Epistemic Modals Are Assessment-Sensitive. In Epistemic Modality, eds. A. Egan and B. Weatherson. New York: Oxford University Press, 144-79.
  • Problems for context-dependent theories and a defense of relativism.
• Moore, G. E. (ed.) 1962. Commonplace Book, 1919-1953. New York: Macmillan.
  • Notes on knowledge, epistemic possibility, and the standard view of epistemic modals.
• Papafragou, A. 2006. Epistemic Modality and Truth Conditions. Lingua 116: 1688-702.
  • An explanation and critique of hedging views of epistemic modals.
• Schnieder, B. 2010. Expressivism Concerning Epistemic Modals. The Philosophical Quarterly 60: 601-615.
  • An explanation and defense of a hedging view of epistemic modals.
• Stanley, J. 2005. Fallibilism and Concessive Knowledge Attributions. Analysis 65: 126-31.
  • An argument that CKAs are self-contradictory and that something like (K1) holds.
• Swanson, E. 2016. The Application of Constraint Semantics to the Language of Subjective Uncertainty. Journal of Philosophical Logic 45: 121-46.
  • An alternative to the standard view of epistemic modals formulated in terms of constraints on an agent’s credences.
• Teller, P. 1972. Epistemic Possibility. Philosophia 2: 303-20.
  • Overview of some accounts of epistemic possibility, including the problem of necessary truths for entailment and probability views.
• von Fintel, K and A. Gillies. 2008. CIA Leaks. The Philosophical Review 117: 77-98
  • A detailed overview of the motivations for context-dependence and relativism about epistemic modal claims.
• Willer, M. 2013. Dynamics of Epistemic Modality. The Philosophical Review 122: 45-92.
  • A dynamic semantics for epistemic modals that rejects the standard view.
• Wright, C. 2007. New Age Relativism and Epistemic Possibility: The Question of Evidence.Philosophical Issues 17: 262-283.
  • A series of objections to relativism and concerns about the motivations for it.
• Yalcin, S. 2007. Epistemic Modals. Mind 116: 983-1026.
  • A presentation of the embedding problem for epistemic modals and a semantics designed to solve it.
• Yalcin, S. 2011. Nonfactualism about Epistemic Modality. In Epistemic Modality, eds. A. Egan and B. Weatherson. New York: Oxford University Press, 295-333.
  • Arguments against the standard view of epistemic modals and development of a nonfactualist account.

 

Author Information

Brandon Carey
Email: brandon.carey@csus.edu
California State University, Sacramento
U. S. A.

Roderick M. Chisholm: Epistemology

Roderick M. Chisholm, a luminary of 20^th century philosophy, is best known for his contributions in epistemology and metaphysics. His groundbreaking theory of knowledge opened the door to the late 20^th and early 21^st century work on the analysis of knowledge, skepticism, foundationalism, internalism, the ethics of beliefs, and evidentialism, to name just a few topics. Chisholm’s analysis of knowledge was the basis of the Gettier problem.

Chisholm responds to skepticism as one of three alternatives to the ancient, insoluble problem of the wheel, which he termed the problem of the criterion—the vicious circle encountered in answering the two fundamental questions of epistemology: ‘What kinds of things can we know?’ and ‘What are the sources of knowledge?’. Answering either requires first answering the other. Chisholm adopts particularism, Thomas Reid’s and G. E. Moore’s ‘common sense’ approach, which proceeds by proposing a tentative answer to the first question, in order to answer the second question.

Chisholm provides an analysis of epistemic justification as a response to the Socratic question “What is the difference between knowledge and true opinion?” He explains justification as epistemic preferability, a primitive relationship based on the epistemic goals and ethics of belief. Chisholm defines terms of epistemic appraisal associated with various levels of justified belief to elucidate the level required for knowledge. The sufficiency of Chisholm’s analysis is examined in light of the Gettier problem.

Chisholm’s epistemology is the standard bearer of foundationalism, first proposed by René Descartes. In its defense, Chisholm proposes a unique answer to explain why empirical knowledge rests on foundational certainties about one’s mental/phenomenal experiences, that is, sense-data propositions.

Chisholm resolves the metaphysical objections to sense-data raised by philosophers such as Gilbert Ryle. Chisholm argues that under certain conditions, sense-data propositions about how things appear are self-presenting, certain, and directly evident—the foundation of empirical knowledge.

Chisholm defines a priori knowledge to explain how necessary truths are also foundational. This definition explains Kant’s claims about synthetic a priori propositions and provides insight into the status of Chisholm’s epistemic principles.

Finally, Chisholm answers the problem of empiricism that plagued philosophers since John Locke, the problem of accounting for the justification of beliefs about the external world (non-foundational propositions) from propositions about the contents of one’s mind (foundational propositions). Chisholm proposes epistemic principles explaining the roles of perception, memory, and coherence (confirmation and concurrence) to complete his account of justification.

Table of Contents

1. Introduction
   1. The Fundamental Questions of Epistemology
   2. Chisholm’s Philosophical Method
2. The Traditional Analysis of Knowledge
   1. Chisholm’s Analysis
   2. The Gettier Problem
3. Why Foundationalism?
   1. The Myth of the Given and the Stopping Place for Socratic Questioning
4. The Directly Evident—The Foundation
   1. Sense-Data and the Problem of the Speckled Hen
   2. The Directly Evident—Seeming, Appearing, and the Self-Presenting
5. The Truths of Reason and A Priori Knowledge
   1. The Justification of A Priori Knowledge
   2. Chisholm, Kant, and the Synthetic A Priori
6. The Indirectly Evident
   1. Chisholm’s Solution to the Problem of Empiricism
   2. Epistemic Principles—Perception and Memory, Confirmation and Concurrence
7. Postscript
8. References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

Roderick M. Chisholm, one of the greatest philosophers of the 20^th century (Hahn 1997), was not only a prolific writer best known for his works on epistemology (theory of knowledge) and metaphysics, but for his many students who became prominent philosophers. In epistemology, Chisholm is best known as the leading proponent of foundationalism, claiming that:

• empirical knowledge is built on a foundation of the evidence of the senses; and
• we have privileged epistemic access to the evidence of our senses.

Foundationalism has its roots in Rene Descartes’ classic work of early modern philosophy, Meditations on First Philosophy. Foundationalism was central to the debate concerning the nature of human knowledge between the Continental Rationalists (Descartes, Spinoza, and Leibniz), the British Empiricists (Locke, Berkeley, and Hume) and Kant. In the 20^th century, Bertrand Russell and A. J. Ayer, luminaries of British Analytic Philosophy, and C. I. Lewis, the American Pragmatist, defended foundationalism; while Logical Positivists, including Hans Reichenbach, a member of the Vienna Circle, argued that foundationalism was untenable. After World War II, Chisholm entered this debate defending foundationalism from attacks by W. V. O. Quine and Wilfred Sellars; all three having been students of C. I. Lewis at Harvard University.

Chisholm’s writings on epistemology first appeared in a 1941 article and his comprehensive and detailed account of perceptual knowledge was first presented in his 1957 book Perceiving (Chisholm 1957). He refined his epistemology over the next forty years in response to counterexamples, objections, and questions raised by his colleagues, students, and critics. These refinements first appeared in Chisholm’s numerous published articles, and were incorporated into the three editions of Theory of Knowledge published in 1966, 1977 and 1989.

Chisholm’s epistemology was unique in not only addressing the “big questions”, but in presenting a detailed theory accounting for the structure of epistemic knowledge and justification.  

a. The Fundamental Questions of Epistemology

Chisholm opens his final edition of Theory of Knowledge addressing the most basic problem of epistemology, the challenge of skepticism—the view that we do not know anything. (For an explanation of skepticism, see: https://iep.utm.edu/epistemo/#SH4b). Chisholm explains that to answer this challenge an answer is required to the question:

1. 1. What do we know or what is the extent of our knowledge?

This, in turn, requires an answer to the question:

1. 2. How are we to decide, in a particular case, whether we know or what are the criteria of knowing?

But, to answer this second question, about the criteria of knowing, we must answer the first question, that is, of what we know. The challenge of skepticism thus ensnares us in the ancient problem of “the diallelus”—the problem of “the wheel”, or, as Chisholm calls it, “the problem of the criterion”. (For a detailed explanation of this problem, see https://iep.utm.edu/criterio/.)

The problem of the criterion can only be resolved by adopting one of three views: skepticism, particularism, or methodism. Skepticism claims that we do not know the extent of our knowledge and we do not know the criteria of knowledge, hence, we do not or cannot know anything. Particularism claims that there are particular propositions or types of propositions that we know, so we have at least a partial answer to the first question, and we can use these paradigm cases of knowledge to develop criteria of knowing, answering the second question. Methodism claims that we can identify certain criteria of knowing, answering the second question, which in turn provides criteria which can be employed to determine the extent of our knowledge, answering the first question.

Chisholm asserts that deciding between these three views cannot be done without involving ourselves in a vicious circle or begging questions: assuming an answer to one or both of the questions posed. That is, Chisholm maintains that the problem of the criterion cannot be solved. Chisholm adopts a “common sense” brand of particularism following in the footsteps of Thomas Reid (the 18^th century Scottish philosopher) and G. E. Moore (the 20^th century English philosopher). The “common sense” assumption is that we know more or less what, upon careful reflection, we think that we know. To justify this working assumption of commonsense particularism, Chisholm sets out as a goal of epistemology to improve our beliefs by ranking them with respect to their relative reasonability. Doing this leads him to adopt an internalist conception of justified belief, presupposing “that one can know certain things about oneself without the need of outside assistance” (Chisholm 1989, pg. 5).

The breadth and depth of Chisholm’s epistemology require focusing here on his solution to four fundamental questions and problems in the theory of knowledge:

1. 1. The analysis of knowledge or, in his terms, the problem of the Theatetus;
   2. Why knowledge must rest on a foundation of sense-data (or why foundationalism)?
   3. What is the nature of the data of the senses (the Directly Evident) and the truths of reason (the a priori), conferring on them privileged epistemic status to serve as a foundation of knowledge?
   4. How is epistemic justification transmitted from sense-data to empirical propositions about the external world (the Indirectly Evident)?

The primary focus of this discussion will be Chisholm’s account of empirical knowledge (or a posteriori knowledge). In the process Chisholm’s account of the knowledge of necessary truths or a priori knowledge is examined.

b. Chisholm’s Philosophical Method

Chisholm introduces his epistemology by clearly articulating the specific philosophical puzzles or problems he proposes to solve, stating the problem unambiguously, presenting his solution clearly defining the terms in which his proposal is cast, considering a series of counterexamples or conceptual tests, and responding to each in detail. This approach not only characterized Chisholm’s philosophical writings, but also his pedagogical methodology. He conducted seminars attended by graduate students and faculty members, at Brown University (where he was on the faculty for virtually his entire academic career) and at the University of Massachusetts at Amherst (to which, for many years, he traveled 100 miles to conduct a weekly seminar). In addition to his colleagues at Brown, notable attendees at these seminars included Edmund Gettier, Herbert Heidelberger, Gareth Matthews, Bruce Aune, Vere Chappell, and his former graduate students Robert Sleigh and Fred Feldman.

Chisholm would present philosophical puzzles and his solutions, and the attendees would challenge his solutions by raising counterexamples, objections, and problems. Chisholm would respond to them, and then return the next week with a revised set of definitions and principles to be defended from the welcomed onslaught of a new set of counterexamples. Honoring this methodology, the Philosophical Lexicon defined a term:

chisholm, v. To make repeated small alterations in a definition or example. “He started with definition (d.8) and kept chisholming away at it until he ended up with (d.8””””).”

2. The Traditional Analysis of Knowledge

Chisholm opens the first edition of Theory of Knowledge (Chisholm 1966) considering Socrates’ claim in Plato’s Meno that, even though he does not know much, he knows that there is a difference between true opinion and knowledge. The Socratic challenge is to explain the difference between knowing a proposition and making a lucky guess. Plato’s answer, known as the Traditional Analysis of Knowledge (TAK), can be expressed as:

(TAK) S knows p =Df	1. S believes (or accepts) p;
	2. p is true; and
	3. S is justified in believing p.
	(where S is the knower and p is a proposition or statement believed).

Thus, according to TAK, the difference between knowing that the Mets won last year’s World Series and making a lucky guess is having an account for, having a good reason for, or being justified in believing that they won the World Series.

Chisholm raises Socrates criticism of the traditional analysis of knowledge in Plato’s Theatetus:

We may say of this type of definition, then, what Socrates said of the attempt to define knowledge in terms of reason or explanation: “If, my boy, the command to add reason or explanation means learning to know and not merely getting an opinion…, our splendid definition of knowledge, would be a fine affair! For learning to know is acquiring knowledge, is it not?” (Theatetus 209E; cited in Chisholm 1966, pg. 7).

Chisholm explains that justified belief is ordinarily understood to presuppose the concept of knowledge. Therefore, the traditional analysis of knowledge appears to be circular, that is, defining knowledge in terms that are themselves defined in terms of knowledge. Chisholm sets out to explain a notion of epistemic justification which inoculates TAK from the charge of pernicious circularity.

a. Chisholm’s Analysis

Chisholm proposes to define knowledge as follows:

(TAK-C) S knows p =Df p is true, S accepts p, and p is evident for S. (Chisholm 1977 pg. 102)

He then undertakes to explain how his version of the traditional analysis avoids the circularity problem of the Theaetetus.

In this analysis the requirement of justified belief, the justification condition of knowledge, is replaced by a condition that the proposition is evident, where evident is a technical term of epistemic appraisal for which Chisholm provides a definition. Roughly speaking, a proposition is evident for a person on the condition that the evidence available to a person is sufficiently strong to constitute a good reason for believing the proposition.

Chisholm does not think that replacing the term justified belief with the term evident magically solves the circularity problem of the Theatetus. In fact, Chisholm concedes that his terms of epistemic appraisal, for example, evident, justified belief, know, more reasonable, certain, beyond reasonable doubt, acceptable, having some presumptions in its favor, gratuitous, and unacceptable, possibly form a closed circle of concepts that cannot be defined in non-epistemic terms. To avoid this seeming circularity, Chisholm first specifies a primitive term which expresses a relationship of epistemic preferability, more reasonable than, explaining this in terms of a specified set of epistemic goals or intellectual requirements of rationality. Next, he defines all of the terms of epistemic appraisal in terms of this primitive relationship. These technical terms, in turn, define various levels of epistemic justification. His final step is to identify the level of epistemic justification, that is, evident, as being the level of justification required for knowledge.

Chisholm fills in the details by providing an ethics of belief and a logic of epistemic terms. The full account of empirical knowledge is completed with a set of epistemic rules or principles, analogous to the rules of morality or logic, explaining the structure of the justification of empirical beliefs. Chisholm believed that the adequacy of a theory of knowledge is dependent on these principles.

The first condition of Chisholm’s analysis of knowledge requires the knower to accept (or, as more commonly expressed, believe) the proposition. Acceptance is one of three mutually exclusive propositional attitudes a person may take with respect to any proposition that he/she considers; the other two being: (1) denying the propositions, that is, accepting the denial (negation) of the proposition, and (2) withholding or suspending judgment about the proposition, that is, neither accepting nor denying the proposition. For example, a person who has considered the proposition that God exists is either (i) a theist who accepts the proposition that God exists, (ii) an atheist who denies that God exists (accepts that ‘God exists’ is false), or (iii) an agnostic who withholds or suspends judgment with respect to the proposition that God exists.

Chisholm draws a parallel between epistemology and ethics to explain epistemic appraisal. Ethics and epistemology are essentially normative or evaluative disciplines. Ethics is concerned with the justification of actions, and analogously, epistemology with the justification of belief (Chisholm 1977 pp. 1-2). A goal of ethics is to provide an account or explanation of moral appraisal, for example, good, right, and so forth. Similarly, epistemology seeks to provide an account or explanation of epistemic appraisal or evaluation. Chisholm’s account of knowledge proceeds by defining knowing a proposition in terms of the proposition’s being evident; and a proposition’s being evident in terms of the primitive relationship of epistemic evaluation, that is, more reasonable than.

Chisholm distinguishes two types of evaluation, absolute and practical, illustrating the distinction as follows. It may have been absolutely morally right to have killed Hitler or Stalin when they were infants, however, it would not have been practically right from the moral standpoint because no one could have foreseen the harm they would cause. Absolute rightness depends on an objective view of reality, that is, taking into consideration all of the truths related to an action. By contrast, practical rightness only depends on what a person could have foreseen.

Chisholm’s view is that justified belief depends on what is practically right for the person to believe. He is committed to the view that epistemic justification and, hence, knowledge, depends on evidence ‘internally’ available to the knower, a view known as Internalism. In support of this view, he points out that we rarely have direct access to the truth of propositions, that is, to reality. Being justified in believing a proposition is dependent on how well believing a given proposition meets the goals or requirements of rationality. The degree to which a proposition meets these goals is relative to the evidence available to a person; not relative to the absolute or ‘God’s eye’ view. Epistemic appraisal or evaluation is a function of the relative rationality of a person’s adopting a propositional attitude (acceptance, denial, withholding) given the evidence available to that person.

In his classic essay “The Ethics of Belief”, W. K. Clifford suggested that “it is always wrong … to believe on the basis of insufficient evidence” (Clifford 1877 pg. 183). In explicating one’s epistemic duties, Chisholm adopts the somewhat lower standard that one’s beliefs are innocent until proven guilty, that is, it is permissible to believe a proposition unless one has evidence to the contrary. At the foundation of Chisholm’s account of justified belief is the primitive concept of epistemic preferability, more reasonable than, which he explains by appealing to “the concept of what might be called an ‘intellectual requirement’.” (Chisholm 1977 pg. 14). He elaborates:

We may assume that every person is subject to a purely intellectual requirement–that of trying his best to bring it about that, for every proposition h that he considers, he accepts h if and only if h is true (Chisholm 1977 pg. 14).

Epistemic preferability, captured by Chisholm’s term more reasonable than, expresses a person’s relationship between two propositional attitudes. The more reasonable propositional attitude is the one that best fulfills one’s epistemic goals/intellectual requirements better than another attitude. Chisholm explains:

What is suggested when we say that one attitude is more reasonable than another is this: If the person in question were a rational being, if his concerns were purely intellectual, and if he were to choose between the two attitudes, then he would choose the more reasonable in preference to the less reasonable. (Chisholm 1966, pp. 21-22).

It may occur to some that this requirement may be satisfied by suspending judgment concerning every proposition, thereby, believing only what is true. However, Chisholm appeals to William James’s criteria, explaining that:

“There are two ways of looking at our duty in the matter of opinion–ways entirely different… We must know the truth: and we must avoid error…”

Each person, then is subject to two quite different requirements in connection with any proposition he considers;         (1) he should try his best to bring it about that if a proposition is true then he believe it; and (2) he should try his best to bring it about that if a proposition is false then he not believe it. (Chisholm 1977 pp. 14-15).

Analogizing believing a proposition to betting on the truth of a proposition is a useful way of thinking about this requirement (Mavrodes 1973). Our epistemic goals can be thought of as providing the bettor with two pieces of advice: (1) win many bets; and (2) lose few bets. If we refrain from betting, we will have followed the second piece of advice and disregarded the first, and, if we bet on everything, we will have followed the first piece of advice to the exclusion of the second.

On Chisholm’s view, the epistemic goals or duties require not merely that we avoid believing false propositions, but that we also strive to find the truth. Our “intellectual requirement” is to strike a happy median between believing everything and believing nothing. While these are two distinct and independent intellectual requirements, one’s epistemic duty is to do one’s best to fulfill both requirements at the same time. If, for example, you saw a small furry animal with a tail in the distance but could not discern what kind of animal it was, you could better fulfill your epistemic duties by believing that it is a dog than denying that it is a dog (believing that it is not a dog); but you would best meet both epistemic goals by withholding or suspending belief rather than by either believing or denying it.

Chisholm elaborates that more reasonable than is a relationship between propositional attitudes p and q which person S may adopt with regard to propositions at time t, which means that “S is so situated at t that his intellectual requirement, his responsibility as an intellectual being, is better fulfilled by p than by q” (Chisholm 1977 pp. 14-15). More reasonable than is an intentional concept, that is, “if one proposition is more reasonable than another for any given subject S, then S is able to understand or grasp the first proposition.” It expresses a transitive and asymmetric relationship. “And finally, if withholding is not more reasonable than believing, then believing is more reasonable than disbelieving” (Chisholm 1977 pg. 13), for example, if agnosticism is not more reasonable than theism, then theism is more reasonable than atheism. Thus, for example, to say that accepting a proposition, p, is more reasonable than denying p for person, S, at time, t, is to say that believing p better fulfills S’s epistemic duties than does S’s denying p. In other words, S ought (epistemically) to accept p rather than deny p, given the evidence available to S.

Chisholm distinguishes levels of justified belief in terms of one propositional attitude being more reasonable than another, given a person’s evidence at a specific time. He defines terms of epistemic appraisal or evaluation that correspond to the level of justification a person has for a given proposition. Chisholm defines these terms to specify a hierarchy of levels of justified belief and specifies the minimum level of justified belief required for knowing. In Chisholm’s hierarchy of justified belief any proposition justified to a specific level is also justified to every lower level.

There is a concept of beyond reasonable doubt that is the standard in English Common Law. This is the level to which the members of the jury must be justified in believing that the accused is guilty in order to render a guilty verdict in a criminal trial. In this context it means that given the available evidence there is no reasonable explanation of the facts other than that the accused person has committed the crime. The underlying idea is an epistemic one, that is, the jurors must have good reason for believing that the accused committed the crime in order to convict the accused.

Chisholm adopts the term beyond reasonable doubt to identify a key level of epistemic justification, that is, when a person has an epistemic duty to believe a proposition. He defines it in a different way than Common Law as follows:

D1.1 h is beyond reasonable doubt for S =Df accepting h is more reasonable for S than withholding h. (Chisholm 1977 pg. 7).

In this sense, a proposition is beyond reasonable doubt for a person if and only if accepting it better fulfills the person’s intellectual requirements of believing all and only true propositions than withholding or suspending belief. More simply put, propositions which are beyond reasonable doubt are ones that a person epistemically ought to believe given the evidence he or she has.

Chisholm considers the proposition that the Pope will be in Rome on October 5^th five years from now as an example of a proposition that has a positive level of justification for most of us, but not quite meeting this standard of beyond reasonable doubt. He points out that although it is more reasonable to believe it than to deny it (given that the Pope is in Rome on most days), but it is even more reasonable to withhold judgment about the Pope’s location five years from now. While the Pope spends most of his time in Rome, circumstances five years from October 5 ^th may require that he be somewhere else. Chisholm defines this slightly lower lever of justified belief, having some presumption in its favor, as follows:

D1.2. h has some presumption in its favor for S =Df Accepting h is more reasonable for S than accepting non-h. (Chisholm 1977 pg. 8).

Given the limited evidence that we have about the Pope’s whereabouts five years from now, it is more reasonable to believe that the Pope will be in Rome than believing that he will not be in Rome five years from October 5^th. However, it is even more reasonable in these circumstances to withhold judgment about the Pope’s whereabouts. According to Chisholm, the proposition in question about the Pope’s whereabouts in the future has some presumption in its favor, that is, it is more reasonable to believe that it is true than false.

Chisholm defines a level of epistemic justification for propositions that are not beyond reasonable doubt and yet have a higher positive epistemic status than having some presumption in their favor. The level of justified belief is that of the proposition’s being acceptable which is defined as follows:

D1.3. h is acceptable for S =Df Withholding h is not more reasonable for S than accepting h. (Chisholm 1977 pg. 9).

An example of a proposition that has this level of justified belief is the proposition that I actually see something red when I seem to see something red under certain questionable lighting conditions. Withholding belief that I actually see something red is not more reasonable than believing it, and yet believing that I actually see something red may not be more reasonable than withholding it, that is, they may be equally reasonable to believe. Anything that is beyond reasonable doubt is acceptable and anything that is acceptable also has some presumption in its favor. As noted in the outset of this discussion, every higher level of justified belief is also justified to every lower level.

Chisholm thinks that while propositions that are beyond reasonable doubt have a high-level justification, that is, they ought to be believed, even though they do not have a sufficiently high level of justification for knowledge. The lower levels of justified belief, that is, acceptable or having some presumption in their favor, play an important role for Chisholm’s account as their level of justification may be raised to the level of evident when they support and are supported by other propositions at the lower levels.

Occupying the high end of Chisholm’s justification hierarchy are proposition which are certain. Chisholm distinguishes this epistemological sense of certain from the psychological sense. We may feel psychologically certain of the truth of a proposition, even though we are not justified in believing it. The epistemological sense of certainty represents the highest level of justified belief and is not merely a feeling of confidence in believing. Chisholm defines certainty as:

D1.4. h is certain for S =Df (i) h is beyond reasonable doubt for S, and (ii) there is no i, such that accepting i is more reasonable for S than accepting h. (Chisholm 1977, pg. 10)

As with all propositions justified to a higher level of epistemic justification, any proposition that is certain for a person also meets the criteria of every lower level of positive epistemic justification. Chisholm claims that propositions that describe the way things appear to a person and some truths of logic and mathematics, under the right conditions, are certain for us. The levels of justification do not come in degrees. Thus, no proposition that is certain, according to Chisholm is more reasonable than (or for that matter less reasonable than) any other proposition having this epistemic status. That is, certainty, in Chisholm’s technical sense, (as every level of justified belief) does not come in degrees.

Some philosophers thought that the criterion of the epistemic justification required for knowledge was certainty. Descartes equated certainty to not being subject to any possible doubt. Chisholm argues that this standard is too high a standard for knowledge because this would rule out, by definition, the possibility of our knowing many contingent truths which we think we can know. This would make skepticism about empirical knowledge true by definition.

Believing that the President is in Washington today because we saw him there yesterday and he spends most of his time there, is beyond reasonable doubt. However, we need stronger justification for knowing that he is there today. Knowledge requires justification to a higher level than the proposition’s merely being beyond reasonable doubt. These considerations indicate to Chisholm that the minimum level of justification required for knowledge is higher than being beyond reasonable doubt and lower than certainty. Capturing this intuition, Chisholm defines evident to single out the level of justification required for knowledge as:

D1.5 h is evident for S =Df (i) h is beyond reasonable doubt for S, and (ii) for any i, if accepting i is more reasonable for S than accepting h, then i is certain. (Chisholm 1977 pg. 10).

According to Chisholm’s version of the Traditional Analysis of Knowledge, a necessary condition of knowledge is that the proposition is evident.

Chisholm’s ethics of belief solves the problem of the Theatetus as follows: He identified the epistemic goals with respect to any proposition under consideration as: (1) believe it if true and (2) do not believe it if false. These goals determine the relative merit of adopting the attitudes of accepting, denying, and withholding judgment with respect to any given proposition and the person’s evidence, that is, in determining which attitude is more reasonable than another. Chisholm’s definition of knowledge identifies the level of justification required for knowing a proposition as being evident, meaning that (i) it is more reasonable for the person to believe the proposition than to withhold belief (beyond reasonable doubt) and (ii) any proposition that is more reasonable is maximally reasonable (certain). This analysis sheds light on the level of justification required for knowing a proposition. Moreover, it is not defined in terms of something which, in turn, is defined in terms of knowledge. Chisholm’s analysis of knowledge thus avoids the circularity problem of the Theatetus.

b. The Gettier Problem

Before leaving the analysis of knowledge to explore the other important parts of Chisholm’s theory of knowledge, a critical objection to Chisholm’s analysis of knowledge, the Gettier Problem, needs to be outlined. Edmund Gettier, in a monumental paper “Is Knowledge Justified True Belief?” (Gettier 1963), proposes a set of counterexamples to Chisholm’s definition of knowledge which identify a genetic defect in the Traditional Analysis of Knowledge. Gettier argues these counterexamples demonstrate a defect in Chisholm’s version of the Traditional Analysis of Knowledge, as well as Plato’s and Ayer’s versions.

To illustrate the problem, let us consider one of Gettier’s examples. Suppose that Smith and Jones are the only two applicants for a job. Smith believes that the person who will get the job has ten coins in his pocket because he knows that he has ten coins in his pocket and that the boss has told him that he will be offered the job. Unbeknownst to Smith, the other applicant, Jones, also has ten coins in his pocket and ultimately gets the job. Thus, Smith believes that the person who has ten coins in his pocket will get the job, it is true, and Smith is justified in believing (it is evident to him) that the person who will get the job has ten coins in his pocket. However, Smith’s evidence is defective and, thus, Smith does not know that the man who will get the job has ten coins in his pocket.

Gettier examples, as they have become known, point to a genetic defect in the Traditional Analysis of Knowledge, that is, a person can have a justified (evident) true belief which is not knowledge. The Gettier problem became a major focus of epistemology in the 1960’s and continues today, more than a half century later. Solutions were proposed that add a fourth condition of knowledge or explain why the Gettier examples were not really problematic. Chisholm notes the Gettier Problem in the first edition of his Theory of Knowledge (Chisholm 1966) suggesting that the solution to the problem lies in adding a fourth condition of knowledge. In his characteristic style, Chisholm presented major revisions of his definitions intended, among other things to address the Gettier Problem, in Theory of Knowledge (Second Edition) in 1977 and in the third edition in 1989.

3. Why Foundationalism?

Chisholm’s epistemology does not begin and end with the analysis of knowledge. His work on the analysis of knowledge clears the conceptual landscape for answering fundamental questions about the structure of empirical knowledge, and for providing an account of the justification of empirical beliefs. In the process, he provides an answer to the much debated question of whether or not empirical knowledge rests on a foundation of epistemically privileged beliefs? Philosophers thought that the answer is obvious, the problem being some maintain it is obviously yes, while others obviously no. Those answering the question in the affirmative defend foundationalism, and those in the negative defend the coherence theory of justification, or simply coherentism.

Chisholm characterizes foundationalism (or the myth of the given as its detractors refer to it) as supporting two claims:

1. The knowledge which a person has at any time is a structure or edifice, many parts and stages of which help support each other, but which as a whole is supported by its foundation.
2. The foundation of one’s knowledge consists (at least in part) of the apprehension of what has been called, variously, “sensations”, “sense impressions”, “appearances”, “sensa”, “sense-qualia”, and “phenomena”. (Chisholm 1946, pp. 262-3).

Chisholm joins philosophy luminaries including Rene Descartes, Bertrand Russell, and C. I. Lewis as a leading defender of foundationalism. However, his unique take on why empirical knowledge rests on a foundation of self-justified beliefs reveals much about his approach to epistemology.

Foundationalism’s historical roots are found in the work of Rene Descartes, the father of Modern Philosophy. In his Meditations on First Philosophy, Descartes embarks on securing a firm basis for empirical knowledge, having discovered many of the beliefs on which he based this knowledge to be false. He proposes to rectify this by purging all beliefs for which there was any possible reason to doubt. By applying this methodological doubt, he finds a set of propositions about which he cannot be mistaken. These include certainties about the contents of his mind, for example, about the way things appear to him. Applying the infallible method of deductive reasoning to this foundation of certainties, Descartes claims to build all knowledge in the way that the theorems of Geometry are derived from axioms and definitions, thereby eliminating possibility of error. Descartes argues that foundationalism is the only way to account for our knowledge of the world external to ourselves, and thereby, refutes skepticism.

Locke, Berkeley, and Hume, the British Empiricists, reject the claim that knowledge requires certainty and argue that Descartes’ deductive proof of the external world is unsound. They agree with Descartes that the foundation of empirical knowledge is sense-data but maintain that knowledge of the external world is merely justified as probable. As this probable justification is fallible and can justify false beliefs, the British Empiricists think that foundationalism is true, but compatible with skepticism.

Bertrand Russell, the 20^th century founder of Anglo-American Analytic Philosophy, picks up the mantle of British empiricism. He too advocates for foundationalism, claiming that we have epistemically privileged access, as he calls it knowledge by acquaintance, to a foundation of sense-data. Russell, like his British Empiricist predecessors, thought that all empirical knowledge rested on this foundation, but did not claim that external world skepticism was refuted by foundationalism.

Russell’s empiricist successors, the logical empiricists or logical positivists, assumed that empirical knowledge was possible as they viewed science as the paradigm example of knowledge. Hans Reichenbach, a leading proponent of logical empiricism, rejects Russell’s and Descartes’ view arguing that empirical knowledge is not justified, and need not be justified, by a set of foundational beliefs to which we have epistemically privileged access. He claimed that, like scientific claims, empirical propositions are justified by their conformance with other merely probably propositions.

C.I. Lewis, a leading figure in 20^th century American Philosophy (and Chisholm’s doctoral dissertation advisor), engages in a famous debate with Reichenbach on this very issue (see: Lewis 1952, Reichenbach 1952, van Cleve 1977, Legum 1980). In “Given Element in Empirical Knowledge”, (Lewis 1952) he argues that empirical knowledge must rest on a foundation of certainty, hence, foundationalism is the only viable alternative. Lewis’s rejection of Reichenbach’s position is based on the claim that there cannot be an infinite regress of justified beliefs. While agreeing that many empirical beliefs are justified because they are probable, he argues:

1. No proposition is probable unless some proposition is certain;
2. Therefore, there cannot be an infinite regress of merely probable beliefs;
3. Some empirical propositions are justified because they are probable;
4. Therefore, empirical knowledge must rest on a foundation of epistemic certainties.

a. The Myth of the Given and the Stopping Place for Socratic Questioning

Chisholm finds Descartes’ approach to epistemology attractive but is not persuaded by Descartes’ defense of foundationalism. Chisholm, also, endorses Lewis’s premise that if any proposition is probable then some proposition is certain (Chisholm 1989, pg. 14), but takes a different tack to defend foundationalism. Chisholm, not one to accept any philosophical dogma on something akin to religious faith, appeals to his method of developing a theory of knowledge in support of foundationalism. He suggests adopting the hypothesis that we know, more or less, what we think we know, and then, by asking Socratic questions about what justifies our believing of the things we think we know, develops the account for their justification.

In Perceiving (Chisholm 1957, pg. 54) and in Theory of Knowledge (Chisholm, 1966 pg. 18) Chisholm compares justifying a belief to confirming a scientific hypothesis. A hypothesis is confirmed by the evidence the scientist has supporting the hypothesis. Similarly, a belief is justified by the evidence a person has that supports its. Scientists often seek out further evidence to confirm the hypothesis. By contrast, only evidence already ‘internally’ possessed, can justify belief.

Chisholm claims that when we consider cases of empirical propositions which we think we know, we discover through Socratic questioning what justifies our believing these propositions. This process may begin by considering a proposition that I think I know, for example, that:

1. 1. There is a tree.

To identify what justifies my believing this, we need to answer the Socratic question, ‘What justifies me in believing this proposition?’. One might mistakenly think that as this proposition is obviously true, that is, that the proper answer to the Socratic question is the proposition itself, that is, that there is a tree. However, this would be to misunderstand what the Socratic question is asking. It is not asking from what other beliefs have I inferred this proposition. The question is, “What evidence do I currently possess that supports my believing this proposition?” Sitting here in my office, looking out my window at a tree, I clearly have evidence that there is a tree, namely, that:

1. 2. I see a tree.

This answer does not imply that I am currently thinking, or have ever thought, about seeing a tree, nor that I consciously believe that I see a tree and from this I infer that there is a tree. It merely implies that the proposition that I see a tree is evidence which is already available to me and which would serve to justify my belief that there is a tree.

This answer, however, is only the first part of a complete answer to the Socratic question “Why do you think that there is a tree?” or “What justifies you in thinking that there is a tree?”. The second part of the answer to the Socratic question is a rule of evidence, in this case a rule specifying conditions related to the proposition serving as evidence which are sufficient for being justified in believing the proposition in question, for example:

RE1. If S is justified in believing that S sees a tree, then S is justified in believing that there is a tree.

The answer to a Socratic question identifies two things: (1) a proposition that serves as evidence for the proposition in question, and (2) a rule of evidence specifying conditions met by the evidence which are sufficient for a person to be justified in believing the proposition in question.

This does not yet amount to a complete account of my being justified in believing that there is a tree. A proposition cannot justify a person’s belief unless the person is justified in believing it. This in turn suggests another step or level is required in the process of Socratic questioning, that is, “What justifies my believing that I see a tree?” The first part of the answer is the evidence that I have for believing this, for example:

1. 3. I seem to see a tree.

This proposition asserts that I am experiencing a certain psychological or phenomenological state of the kind that I would have in cases where I am actually seeing a tree, dreaming that I am seeing a tree, or hallucinating that I am seeing a tree. The second part of the answer to this question is a rule of evidence, in this case:

RE2. If S is justified in believing that S seems to see a tree and has no evidence that S is not seeing a tree, then S is justified in believing that S sees a tree.

This in turn raises the next step or level in the process of Socratic questioning, that is, “What justifies my believing that I seem to see a tree?” The appropriate answer to this question in this case is not some other proposition that serves as evidence that I seem to see a tree. Rather, the truth of the proposition, that is, my having the psychological experience of seeming to see a tree, is my evidence for believing that I seem to see a tree. The second part of the answer is a rule of evidence like the following:

RE3. If it is true that S seems to see a tree, then S am justified in believing that S seems to see a tree.

This rule of evidence is a different kind than the others encountered in the process of Socratic questioning. This rule conditions justified belief on the truth of a proposition, in contrast to the other rules which condition justified belief on being justified in believing another proposition.

Chisholm questions whether our process of Socratic questioning goes on without end, ad infinitum, by either justifying one claim with another or by going around in a circle? He believes that “…if we are rational beings, we will do neither of these things. For we will find that our Socratic questions lead us to a proper stopping place.” (Chisholm 1977, pg. 19). We come to a final empirical proposition whose justification is that the proposition believed is true.

When we encounter an answer that the truth of the proposition justifies believing the proposition, Chisholm points out, we have reached the stopping place of Socratic questioning, that is, we have completed the account of the justification of the initial proposition. Furthermore, according to Chisholm, we typically find that the proposition reached at the end of the process of Socratic questioning describes the person’s own psychological state, that is, describes the way things appear to that person. Thus, at least hypothetically, Chisholm identifies a class of beliefs which may serve as the foundation of all empirical knowledge. This is tantamount to saying that if we know any empirical or perceptual propositions, then believing these propositions is, at least in part, justified by the relationship they have to the psychological proposition describing the way things appear to us.

Chisholm claims that when we consider cases of empirical propositions which we think we know, we discover that the process of Socratic questioning, that is, that the account of the justification for believing these propositions, comes to a proper stopping place in a finite number of steps. When we reach the final stage of Socratic questioning, we have discovered, as foundationalism implies, the foundation on which empirical knowledge rests. In contrast to Descartes, Chisholm does not think that the only alternative to skepticism is foundationalism. While he may agree with C. I. Lewis that you cannot have an infinite regress of propositions which are probable, he does not claim that this proves that that there is no viable alternative to foundationalism. Chisholm thinks that the fact that we find a proper stopping place to Socratic questioning makes it plausible to accept foundationalism as a postulate or an axiom for developing a theory of knowledge. That foundationalism is acceptable, for Chisholm, should be judged by how well it explains the justification of empirical beliefs. Thus, to defend foundationalism, Chisholm presents one of the most detailed and complete explanations answering the two fundamental questions: (i) What makes the foundational beliefs about one’s psychological states or sense-data ‘self-justified’ (as Chisholm calls them, ‘directly evident’)?, and (ii) How does the foundation of sense-data serve as the ultimate justification of all empirical knowledge? Chisholm’s answer to these two critical questions is thus discussed in the next section.

4. The Directly Evident—The Foundation

Descartes proposed that empirical knowledge must rest on a foundation of certainties, propositions about which one cannot be mistaken. His foundation was composed of propositions about which even an all-powerful and all-knowing evil genius could not deceive him. It included not only logical or necessary truths, but also psychological propositions about himself. These propositions are of the form that I exist…, I doubt …., I understand …, I affirm …, I deny …, I imagine …., and, most importantly, I have sensory perceptions of … . Propositions of the last type, that is, propositions about one’s psychological or phenomenological states describing the raw data of the senses, are perhaps the most crucial propositions upon which all empirical knowledge is founded. These sense-data propositions, expressed by statements like ‘I seem to see a fire’, describe the inner workings of one’s mind, and do not imply the existence of anything in the external world.

Locke, Berkeley, and Hume (the British Empiricists) recognize that the data of the senses, that is, sense-data, serves as the foundation of empirical knowledge. Bertrand Russell agrees with them that these propositions constitute the foundation of empirical knowledge and claims that they have a privileged epistemic status which he dubbed knowledge by acquaintance. C. I. Lewis agreed that empirical knowledge rests on a foundation of sense-data, which are the given element in empirical knowledge.

Many 20^th century empiricists were skeptical about the existence of sense-data which led to their doubting that empirical knowledge rests on a foundation of epistemically privileged sense-data. Gilbert Ryle, for example, raised this type of objection and argued that sense-data theory is committed to an untenable view of the status of appearance. Chisholm enters the historical debate, defending foundationalism from Ryle’s objection in one of his earliest papers on epistemology, “The Problem of the Speckled Hen” (Chisholm 1942).

a. Sense-Data and the Problem of the Speckled Hen

Ryle asks you to suppose you take a quick look at a speckled hen which has 48 speckles that are in your field of vision. According to the view under consideration you have a 48 speckled sense-datum. If, as foundationalism claims, you can never be wrong about the sense-data that present themselves to the mind, it would seem that you could never be mistaken in thinking that you were presented with a 48 speckled datum. Ryle’s point is that while we might concede that one could never be mistaken in thinking that a sense-datum had two or three speckles, but, as the number of speckles gets sufficiently large, for example, 48, we may be mistaken the number of speckles in the sense-datum. Chisholm points out that this is not an isolated problem in an odd situation, but that similar issues can be raised concerning most perceptual presentations, that is, most sense-data are complex like the speckled hen case.

A.J. Ayer, a leading logical positivist and a defender of foundationalism, replies that the example is mistaken, arguing that any inaccuracy introduced in counting the speckles can be accounted for because sense-data do not have any definite number of speckles. (Ayer 1940). Chisholm points out that it is odd to think that the sense-data caused by a looking at a hen having a definite number of speckles do not have a specific number of speckles. Thus, Ayer must adopt either of two unacceptable positions. The first is that it is neither true nor false that the hen sense-datum has 48 speckles. This amounts to saying that certain propositions expressing sense-data are neither true nor false. But this is hardly acceptable because it would commit one to denying the logical law of the excluded middle. The alternative would be that while the hen sense-datum had many speckles, it did not have any specific number of speckles. Chisholm argues that this is untenable because it is like claiming that World War II would be won in 1943, but not in any of the months that make up 1943.

Chisholm thinks that the Problem of the Speckled Hen demonstrates that not all sense-data propositions are foundational. One’s justification for believing complicated sense-data propositions, for example, that I seem to see a 48 specked hen, are not the propositions themselves, but are other sense-data propositions, for example, that I seem to see an object with red speckles. Chisholm grants that complex sense-data propositions can and often do refer to judgments that go past what is presented or given in experience. Such propositions assign properties to our experience that compare the given experience to another experience. Any such judgment goes beyond what is given or presented in the experience and, as such, introduces the possibility of being mistaken in the comparison. When a sense-data judgment goes beyond what is presented in experience, its justification is not the truth of the proposition, but is justified by other simpler sense-data which in turn are either simpler or foundational.

Chisholm’s concludes that the class of sense-data proposition is larger than the class of epistemically foundational or basic propositions. Only the subset comprised of simple sense-data propositions, for example, propositions about colors and simple shapes that appear, may be foundational beliefs. The challenge for Chisholm is two-fold: (a) to provide an account of which sense-data propositions are foundational, or as he calls them Directly Evident, that avoids the metaphysical pitfalls Ryle identified with sense-data; and (b) to identify what enables them to serve as the foundation of perceptual knowledge, that is, to explain their privileged epistemic status.

b. The Directly Evident—Seeming, Appearing, and the Self-Presenting

In short, Chisholm claims that to discover what justifies our believing some proposition can be determined by a process of Socratic questioning which identifies the evidence we have for believing the proposition, and then the evidence we have for believing the evidence, until we reach a proper stopping point. The proper stopping point arises when the proper answer is that the evidence that justifies one in believing the proposition is the truth of the proposition. These propositions whose truth constitutes their own evidence are the given element in empirical knowledge, that is, the Directly Evident.

The following example of a line of Socratic questioning illustrates Chisholm’s point. Suppose I know that:

1. 1. There is a blue object.

In response to the question of what evidence I have for believing this I may cite that:

1. 2. I perceive (see, feel, hear, and so forth) that there is a blue object.

In response to the question of what evidence I have for accepting (2), I would cite that:

1. 3. I seem to see to see something blue (or alternatively that I have a blue sense-datum).

When we reach an answer like (3), we have reached Chisholm’s proper stopping point of Socratic questions. On Chisholm’s view, psychological or phenomenological propositions like (3) are self-justifying or self-presenting, they are the given element in empirical knowledge, and they serve as the foundation of perceptual knowledge.

Chisholm defends Descartes’ and C. I. Lewis’ assertion that propositions which describe a person’s phenomenological experience, that is, propositions which describe the way that things seem or appear to a person, are important constituents of the foundation of perceptual knowledge. These phenomenological propositions which constitute the foundation of perceptual knowledge are expressed by statements using ‘appears’ or ‘seems’, and they do not imply that one believes, denies, has evidence supporting, or that is hedging about whether there is something that actually has a certain property. Rather, ‘appears’ or ‘seems’ describes one’s sensory or phenomenological state, for example, that I seem to see something white.

Chisholm distinguishes comparative and non-comparative uses of ‘appears’ in statements describing one’s sensations or phenomenological state. The comparative use describes the way that we are appeared to by comparing it with the way that certain physical objects have appeared in the past. Thus, when I use ‘appears’ in the comparative way, I am “saying that there is a certain manner of appearing, f, which is such that: (1) something now appears f, and (2) things that are blue may normally be expected to appear f.” (Chisholm 1977 pg. 59). By contrast, if I use ‘appears’ in the noncomparative way, I am saying that there is a blue way of appearing (or seeming) and I am now in this phenomenological state or having this kind of phenomenological experience. Chisholm claims that only those propositions expressed by sentences using the noncomparative descriptive phenomenological sense of ‘appear’ or ‘seems’ are directly evident.

Chisholm’s solution to the Problem of the Speckled Hen is that sense-data compose the given element in empirical knowledge, that is, the foundation on which all perceptual knowledge stands, but not all sense-data are foundational. Only sense-data statements referring to some sensory characteristics are candidates for this special status, and they can be called basic sensory characteristics. It should be said that, at least for most of us, the characteristic like the speckled hen’s appearing to have 48 speckles are not basic sensory characteristics, and therefore are not foundational beliefs. Rather, only appearance propositions using the basic or simple sensory characteristics, for example, basic visual characteristics (for example, blue, green, red), olfactory characteristics, gustatory characteristics, auditory characteristics, or tactile characteristics, will be candidates for the directly evident.

One might wonder what distinguishes appearing blue from appearing to have 48 speckles that makes the former a basic sensory characteristic while the latter not. Most people can recognize a triangle at a glance and do not need to count the three sides or angles in order to recognize that the object is a triangle. Moreover, at a glance, we can distinguish it from a square, rectangle, or pentagon. Contrast that with recognizing a chiliagon (1000 sided polygon). Other than perhaps a few geometric savants (perhaps Thomas Hobbes who attempted to make a polygon into a circle), we cannot recognize a chiliagon at a glance. In fact, we would have to go through a long process of counting to discover that a given polygon in fact had 1000 sides. Clearly, appearing chiliagon shaped is not going to be a basic sensory characteristic in contrast to appearing triangular.

Like most adults I can discern a triangle immediately, while very young children cannot. A child playing with a toy containing holes of different shapes and blocks to be inserted into the corresponding shaped hole may have difficulty matching the triangle to the triangular hole, indicating that it is difficult for the very young child to recognize a triangle. It seems reasonable to conclude that appearing triangular is a basic sensory characteristic for me but not for the very young child. Thus, one and the same characteristic may be a basic sensory characteristic for one person while not a basic characteristic for another depending on their visual acuity. Moreover, visual acuity may change from time to time for the same person, hence, at different times, the same characteristic may be a basic sensory characteristic at one time and not at another time. (Chudnoff 2021 discusses empirical evidence that training can help one develop new recognitional abilities).

The distinction between basic sensory characteristics from non-basic ones is based on whether or not a person requires evidence to be justified in believing that the sensation has a certain characteristic. For most of us (at least those of us who are not color-blind), being justified in believing the proposition that I seem to see something green would require no evidence beyond our phenomenological state or experience. By contrast, being justified in believing that I seem to see a 48 speckled thing would require our having evidence from counting up the speckles. Thus, being 48 speckled would not be a basic sensory characteristic. By contrast, being 5 speckled (or fewer) for most of us would be a basic sensory characteristic. The test of whether a sensory characteristic is basic would be the answer to the Socratic question of what justifies the person in believing that it is an experience of that characteristic.

Chisholm’s solution to the Problem of the Speckled Hen addresses the metaphysical concerns about sense-data. A standard view of sense-data is that if I am looking at a white wall that is illuminated by red lights, there is a red wall sense-datum, which is really red and this object is what ‘appears before my mind’. Philosophers have objected to the sense-data theory’s dependence upon the existence of non-physical ghost-like entities serving as intermediaries between physical objects and the perceiver. Ayer, for example, proposed that these odd metaphysical entities may have seemingly contradictory properties, for example, having many speckles but no specific number of speckles. Others rejected these metaphysical claims as entailing skepticism about the external world as we only have access to the sense-data. Chisholm intends his theory to account for the epistemic properties of sense-data, that is, that they are directly evident, without entailing the objectionable metaphysical assumption sense-data are ghost-like entities.

Chisholm explains that if we are going to be precise, something appears f to me is not directly evident because this implies that there are objects, sense-data, which appear to me and for which it is proper to seek further justification. Consider a case of my hallucinating a green table and as a result it is true that:

I seem to see a green table.

A defender of sense-data would say that this means the same as:

There is a green sense datum which is appearing to me.

But, it is perfectly proper to seek justification for the belief that a green sense-datum exists, hence, the proposition that I seem to see a green table is not directly evident.

Such examples suggest to Chisholm that a better formulation of the statement which expresses the directly evident is “I am experiencing an f appearance.” “But,” he is concerned that, “in introducing the substantive ‘appearances’ we may seem to be multiplying entities beyond necessity.” (Chisholm 1977, pg. 29). Chisholm, therefore, wants to avoid referring to any unusual entities like sense-data in statements intended to express the directly evident. The reason cited for avoiding references to sense-data is parsimony, that is, the principle of assuming the existence of no more types of objects than required.

Chisholm shows us how to get rid of the substantives in appear-statements. We begin with a statement:

a. Something appears white to me;

which is to be rewritten more clearly as:

b. I have a white appearance.

But this sentence contains the substantive ‘appearance’. To avoid reference to any strange metaphysical entities, sense-data, the sentence must be rewritten to read as:

c. I am appeared white to.

Chisholm notes that we have not yet succeeded in avoiding referring to sense-data, for ‘white’ is an adjective and, thus, must describe some entity (at least according to the rules of English grammar). We, however, want ‘white’ to function as an adverb that describes the way that I am appeared to. Thus, the sentence becomes:

d. I am appeared whitely to;

 or, to put it in a somewhat less awkward way,

e. I sense whitely.

Chisholm does not propose that we should use this terminology in our everyday discourse, nor even that we should use this terminology whenever we are discussing epistemology. Rather, he wants us to keep in mind that when we use sentences like (a), (b), and (c) to express the foundation of empirical knowledge, what we are asserting is what (d) and (e) assert.

Chisholm concludes that (d) and (e), the directly evident propositions, do not imply that there are non-corporeal entities, sense-data, that are something over and above the physical objects and their properties which we perceive. When our senses deceive us, we are not seeing, hearing, feeling, smelling, or tasting (that is, perceiving) a non-physical entity. Rather, we are misperceiving or sensing wrongly, which is why Chisholm calls this the Adverbial Theory. We are sensing in a way that, if taken at face value, gives us prima facie evidence for a false proposition, that is, that we are actually perceiving something that has this property, hence, we do know the proposition we are perceiving something to have this property.

Chisholm maintains that our empirical knowledge rests on a foundation of propositions expressed by true noncomparative appear statements which we are sufficiently justified in believing to know, or to use his technical term, are evident. He further asserts that they have the highest level of epistemic justification, that is they are certain. However, in saying that they are certain, Chisholm is not endorsing Descartes’ view that they are incorrigible, that is, that we can never be wrong in believing these propositions. Nonetheless, Chisholm is agreeing with Descartes that they have a special level of justification., that is, they are in some sense self-evident or, as he prefers, directly evident.

To explain this special epistemic status Chisholm appeals to Gottfried Wilhelm Leibniz’s notion of primary truths, which are of two types: primary truths of reason and primary truths of fact. A paradigm primary truth of reason is a mathematical truth like a triangle has three sides. Such truths are knowable, a priori, independently of experience, because the predicate of the statement, having three sides, is contained in the subject, triangle (Leibniz 1916, Book IV Chapter IX). Knowing primary truths of reason requires no proof, rather they are immediately obvious. Leibniz claims that similarly our knowledge of our own existence and our thoughts (the contents of our own minds) are primary truths of fact immediately known through experience, a posteriori. There is no difference between our knowing them, their being true, and our understanding or being aware of them.

Leibniz likens our immediately intuiting the truth of basic logical truths to our direct awareness of our psychological or phenomenological states at the time they occur. We are directly aware of both primary truths of reason and experience because the truth of the propositions themselves is what justifies us in believing them. We reach the proper stopping point in Socratic questioning when have reached a primary truth of fact, a proposition describing our psychological or phenomenological state when it occurs. Its truth (or the occurrence of the state) constitutes our immediate justification in believing, hence, knowing such propositions. There is no need to appeal to any other reason that justified our believing them, hence, they are directly evident.

In explaining the epistemic status of appearance, Chisholm appeals to Alexis Meinong’s observation that psychological or phenomenological states of affairs expressed by propositions of the form: ‘I think …’, ‘I believe …’, ‘I am appeared to …’, and so forth, are self-presenting in the sense that whenever these propositions are true, they are certain for the person (Chisholm 1989 pg. 19). Thus, when one is appeared to whitely (in the non-comparative sense of appeared to) one is justified in believing it and there is no proposition that the person is more justified in believing. On Chisholm’s view these self-presenting propositions, for example, about the way things (non-comparatively) appear are paradigm examples of the directly evident, hence, serve as the foundation of empirical knowledge.

Chisholm explains that while all self-presenting propositions are directly evident, not all directly evident propositions are self-presenting. The directly evident, the foundation on which empirical knowledge rests, also contains propositions that are related to, but are not themselves, propositions that are self-presenting. Chisholm writes:

But isn’t it directly evident to me now both that I am thinking and that I do not see a dog? The answer is yes. But the concept of the directly evident is not the same as that of the self-presenting. (Chisholm 1977, pg. 23)

Thus, according to Chisholm, the foundation of empirical knowledge is comprised of a broader class of propositions that include the class of self-presenting propositions, their logical implications, and the negation of the self-presenting. He uses the term directly evident to designate this class of foundational beliefs, which he defines as:

Def 2.2  h is directly evident for S =Df. h is logically contingent; and there is an e such that (i) e is self-presenting for s, and (ii) necessarily, whoever accepts e accepts h. (Chisholm 1977 pp. 23-24)

Thus, for example, Descartes’ first foundational proposition, that I exist, is directly evident for me whenever I think, for this later proposition is self-presenting for me, and (per Descartes’s insight) necessarily whoever accepts the proposition, that I think, accepts the proposition, that I exist.

The class of propositions which are directly evident for a person include propositions concerning a person’s occurrent beliefs and thoughts and propositions describing the way that things appear to a person. These latter propositions are expressed by noncomparative appear-statements of the form, ‘I am appeared F-ly to’. This class of propositions serve as the foundation of knowledge, the set propositions in relationship to which all other propositions are justified.

5. The Truths of Reason and A Priori Knowledge

Leibniz divided true propositions into two types: truths of reason and truths of fact. Truths of reason are necessarily true and their negation is impossible, while truths of fact are contingent and their negation is possible. Leibniz’s division is also based on the source of knowledge of propositions of each kind. We find out that a necessary proposition is true by analyzing it into simpler ideas or truths until we reach what he calls ‘primary truths’. He concludes that the source of knowledge of necessary truths is reason and can be known a priori, that is, independently of experience, while the source of knowledge of contingent truths is experience and can be known a posteriori.

The focus to this point has been on Chisholm’s views on the empirical foundation of knowledge or foundational knowledge a posteriori. Chisholm believes that some of our knowledge is based on necessary truths which are known a priori. He provides the following account of the justification of necessary truths, including logical truths, mathematical truths, and conceptual truths, explaining how some of these truths serve as evidence for empirical knowledge.

a. The Justification of A Priori Knowledge

Chisholm appeals to Leibniz, Frege (the late 19^th and early 20^th century German philosopher, logician, and mathematician), and Aristotle to explain the basis of a priori knowledge. Leibniz writes: “The immediate awareness of our existence and of our thoughts furnishes us with the first a posteriori truths of facts… while identical propositions”, [propositions of the form A=A], “embody the first a priori truths or truths of reason… Neither admits of proof, and each can be called immediate.” (Leibniz 1705, Book IV, Ch 9). The traditional term for Leibniz’s first truths of reason is ‘axioms’. Frege explains: “Since the time of antiquity an axiom has been taken to be a thought whose truth is known without being susceptible by a logical train of reasoning” (Chisholm 1989 pg. 27). Chisholm explains the meaning of ‘incapable of proof’ by appealing to Aristotle’s suggestion in Prior Analytics that “[a]n axiom or ‘basic truth’… is a proposition ‘which has no proposition prior to it’; there is no other proposition which is ‘better known’ than it is” (Chisholm 1989 pg. 27).

Chisholm proposes that axioms are necessary propositions known a priori serving as foundational propositions. They are similar in the following respect to the self-presenting (directly evident) propositions about how we are appeared to, for example, that we are appeared redly to. When we are appeared to in a certain way, we are justified in believing the proposition that we are appeared to in this way; in Chisholm’s terminology, they are evident to us. We ‘immediately’ know about these mental states because they present themselves to us. Analogously, there are some necessary truths which are evident to us ‘immediately’ upon thinking about them.

Chisholm defines axioms, the epistemically foundational propositions, as follows:

D1	h is an axiom =Df h is necessarily such that (i) it is true, and (ii) for every S, if S accepts h, then h is certain for S. (Chisholm 1989 pg. 28)

His examples of axioms include:

If some men are Greeks, then some Greeks are men;
The sum of 5 and 3 is 8;
All squares are rectangles.

Notice that according to this definition, if a person accepts a proposition which is an axiom, the proposition is certain for that person. But being an axiom is not sufficient for the proposition’s being evident or justified for a person. The person may never have considered the proposition or, worse, may believe or accept that it is false, and hence cannot be justified in believing it at all. To be sufficient for an axiom is to be certain or evident (justified) for a person, and the person must also accept the proposition.

Chisholm, therefore, adds the condition that the person accepts the proposition, defining a proposition’s being axiomatic for S as:

D2	h is axiomatic for S =Df (i) h is an axiom, and (ii) S accepts h. (Chisholm 1989 pg. 28).

Thus, for the proposition that all squares are rectangles to be axiomatic for a person requires not only that the proposition be an axiom, that is, necessarily true and necessarily such that if the person accepts it then it is certain for the person, but also that the person believes or accepts the proposition. Note that a proposition which is axiomatic for a person has the highest level of justification for the person, putting axiomatic propositions on a par, epistemically, with propositions that are directly evident.

Chisholm claims that the class of propositions that are axiomatic is the class of foundational propositions known a priori. There are also non-foundational propositions known a priori. For example, propositions that are implied by axioms may also be known a priori. However, it is not sufficient that the axiom implies the other proposition for the second proposition to be known a priori, as that would imply that all implications of axioms are also justified, whether the person is aware of the implications or not. Rather, it must also be axiomatic for the person that the axiom implies the other proposition. Suppose, for example, that it is axiomatic for a person that all interior angles of a rectangle are right angles, and also that it is axiomatic for that person that something’s being a square implies that it is a rectangle. In that case, the proposition that all the interior angles of a square are right angles is also known a priori for that person.

As it is axiomatic for every person that any proposition implies itself, axiomatic propositions are also known a priori. The theorems of logic or mathematics are also known a priori, as long as the person accepts the axiom and as long as it is axiomatic for that person that the axiom implies the theorem. Chisholm adds these additional propositions to the class of a priori knowledge by defining a priori knowledge as:

D3	h is known a priori by S =Df There is an such that (i) e is axiomatic for S, (ii) the proposition, e implies h, is axiomatic for S, and (iii) S accepts h. (Chisholm 1989 pg. 29)

Chisholm defines a proposition’s being a priori as:

D4	h is a priori =Df It is possible that there is someone for whom h is known a priori. (Chisholm 1989 pg. 31).

b. Chisholm, Kant, and the Synthetic A Priori

Kant distinguished two types of a priori propositions, analytic and synthetic. Roughly, an analytic proposition is one in which the predicate adds nothing new to the subject, for example, ‘all squares are rectangles’. It asserts that a component of the complex concept of the subject, for example, square or equilateral rectangle, is the concept of the predicate, rectangle. The underlying idea is that the concept of the subject can be analyzed in a way that it includes the concept of the predicate. By contrast, synthetic propositions are propositions in which the predicate is ascribing properties to the subject over and above what is contained in the concept of the subject, for example, the square is large.

It is generally thought that analytic propositions are not only necessarily true, but also a priori. However, as analytic propositions seem to be redundant and trivial, they appear to contribute little or no content to a person’s knowledge. This led Kant to raise the much-debated question of whether there are propositions which are synthetic and known a priori.

Chisholm argues that much of the debate concerning Kant’s question is based on a much broader concept of ‘analytic’ than the one which Kant had in mind. To clarify the epistemological importance of Kant’s question, Chisholm provides definitions of ‘analytic’ and ‘synthetic’. Underlying the concept of an analytic proposition are two concepts, that of a property implying another property and two properties being conceptually equivalent. He defines the first as:

D5	The property of being F implies the property of being G =Df The property of being F is necessarily such that if something exemplifies it then something exemplifies the property of being G. (Chisholm 1989 pg. 33)

Thus, for example, the property of being a bachelor implies the property of being single. A bachelor is necessarily such that if something is a bachelor, then something is a single person. He then defines what it is for two properties to be conceptually equivalent as:

D6	P is conceptually equivalent to Q =Df Whoever conceives P conceives Q, and conversely. (Chisholm 1989 pg. 33)

For example, the property of being a bachelor is conceptually equivalent to being a single male, as anyone conceiving of or thinking of a bachelor conceives of a single male, and vice versa, anyone who conceives of a single male conceives of a bachelor.

Chisholm defines the concept an ‘analytic proposition’ in terms of the forgoing concepts as follows:

D7	The proposition that all Fs are Gs is analytic =Df The property of being F is conceptually equivalent to a conjunction of two properties, P and Q, such that: (i) P does not imply Q, (ii) Q does not imply P, and (iii) the property of being G is conceptually equivalent to Q. (Chisholm 1989 pg. 34)

A proposition which is not analytic is synthetic, as per the following definition:

D8	The proposition that all Fs are Gs is synthetic =Df The proposition that all Fs are Gs is not analytic. (Chisholm 1989 pg. 34)

Chisholm’s definitions clarify the philosophical importance of Kant’s question, which is whether a synthetic proposition—a proposition in which the predicate cannot be found in the analysis of the subject, that is, a proposition that is not redundant and adds content to the subject—can be known to be true a priori. Finding such a proposition implies that “the kind of cognition that can be attributed to reason alone may be more significant” (Chisholm 1989 pg. 34).

Chisholm suggests that there are four types of examples of synthetic a priori propositions. Examples of the first type are the propositions expressed by the following sorts of sentences: “Everything that is a square is a thing that has shape” and “Everyone who hears a something in C-sharp major hears a sound”. Some have claimed that the property of being a square is conceptually equivalent to the properties of having a shape and some additional properties. The second possible type of synthetic a priori propositions are referred to by Leibniz as ‘disparates’. An example of such a proposition is ‘Nothing that is red is blue’. Chisholm notes that while attempts have been made to show propositions of these two types to be analytic, none has been successful.

The third possible type of synthetic a priori propositions are statements of moral judgments like the one expressed by the following sort of sentence: “All pleasures, as such, are intrinsically good, or good in themselves, whenever and wherever they may occur”. Chisholm concurs with Leibniz’s assertion that while such propositions can be known, no experience of the senses could serve as evidence in their favor.

The final possible type of synthetic a priori propositions are propositions of arithmetic. Kant asserted that propositions like 2 +1 = 3 are not analytic, hence, they are synthetic. Some might question whether the propositions they assert are of the right form, that is, all Fs are Gs, but there may be a way to formulate them into the ‘all Fs are Gs’ form. While the principles of arithmetic have been analyzed in terms of sets, this has not been done in such a way that the predicate can be analyzed out of the subject, in which case they have yet to be shown to be analytic.

While various epistemic principles to account for the justification of certain types of propositions are discussed in this section, more of these epistemic principles are examined in the next one. Chisholm’s use of these principles raises meta-epistemological questions related to the status of these principles and the nature of epistemology itself. Are the epistemic principles necessary or contingent? Can they be known a priori or a posteriori? And are they analytic or synthetic? While Chisholm’s answers to these questions are not clear, it would not be surprising if he thought that they are synthetic a priori necessary truths.

6. The Indirectly Evident

Chisholm’s account of the Directly Evident, explains and defends one of the two main theses of foundationalism. It identified a set of propositions describing one’s psychological or phenomenological states, the way things appear or seem, as being self-presenting. These propositions and some of their logical consequences are epistemic certainties composing the directly evident foundation of empirical knowledge. The second main thesis of foundationalism is that these directly evident propositions ultimately serve, at least in part, as the justification of all empirical knowledge. To complete his theory of knowledge Chisholm undertakes to explain how empirical propositions which are indirectly evident are justified. In the process Chisholm undertakes to solve the problem of empiricism that has plagued epistemology since Descartes.

Chisholm’s account of the Indirectly Evident proposes to answer the fundamental question of how propositions about the external world are justified by propositions about one’s internal psychological experiences or states, solving what he calls the problem of empiricism. This problem finds its roots in Descartes and was inherited by his British Empiricist successors, Locke, Berkeley, and Hume.

Descartes proposed to solve this problem by employing deductive logic. Starting from his discovered foundation of certainties, composed of propositions about the contents of his mind and some necessary truths that could be proven with certainty, he sets out to prove the truth of propositions about the external world. Following his method of Geometric proof (deductive logic), he sets out to derive, through deductive reasoning the existence of the external world from the empirical certainties about the contents of his mind and some other necessary truths.

Descartes argues that, for example, when he is having a certain sort of visual experience, he is certain of the proposition that I seem to see something red. From this certainty and some additional logical certainties, among them being the proposition that God exists and is not a deceiver (for which he provides deductive proofs) using deductive reasoning he derives propositions about the external world, for example, that there is something red. In this manner, Descartes purports to have built knowledge about the external world, from foundational certainties using only deductive reasoning, a method which cannot go wrong. This epistemological program, its methodology and its associated philosophy of mind earned Descartes, and his European continental successors Baruch Spinoza and Gottfried Wilhelm Leibniz, the title of Continental Rationalists.

John Locke, the progenitor of British Empiricism, claims that all knowledge of the external world is based on experience. He argues that Descartes’ demonstrations are flawed, claiming that knowledge of the external world cannot be justified by applying deductive reasoning to the foundational propositions. Locke argues that a fundamental mistake in Descartes’ program is setting the standard of certainty for knowledge and epistemic justification too high. On Locke’s view, avoiding skepticism merely requires the probability of truth to account for the transfer of justified belief from the contents of the mind to propositions about the external world.

To account for the transfer of justification, Locke appeals to his empiricist philosophy of mind according to which the mind is a blank slate, a tabula rasa, upon which sense-data is deposited. The data provided by the senses is the source knowledge about the world. Knowledge of the external world is ultimately justified by the experience of the senses. Locke, allowing for fallible epistemic justification, claims that one can be completely justified in believing a proposition that is not entailed by the evidence or reasons that one has for believing the proposition.

Locke claims that the move from one’s sensing something to be red to the proposition that there is something that is red is justifiable because of the resemblance between the contents of one’s minds (sensations and ideas) and objects in the external world which cause these sensations and ideas. Thus, for example, we are justified in believing the proposition that I am actually seeing something red because our idea or mental representation of the red thing resembles the object which caused it. Thus, according to Locke, any proposition about the external world is justified only if the mental representation resembles the corresponding physical object.

George Berkeley, Locke’s successor, finds Locke’s justification of beliefs about physical objects from their resemblance to the contents of one’s mind problematic. Berkeley is concerned that this inference is justifiable if, and only if, we have reason to think that the external world resembles our ideas. To be justified in believing that there is a resemblance one would have to be able to compare the ideas and the physical object. However, we cannot possibly compare the two. Noting that on Locke’s view we only have epistemic access to our ideas, Berkeley objects that this inference is problematic. We can never get “outside our minds” to observe the physical object and compare it to our mental image of it, and thus, we can have no reason to think that one resembles the other. Berkeley concludes that Locke’s view entails skepticism about the external world, that is, the belief that no empirical beliefs about the external world could ever be justified.

To avoid these skeptical consequences while maintaining that knowledge of the external world is based on sense-data, Berkeley advocates phenomenalism, the view captured by his slogan “esse est percipi” (“to be is to be perceived”). (Berkeley 1710, Part I Section 3). Berkeley’s phenomenalism claims that physical objects are made up of sense-data which are the permanent possibility of sensation. There are no physical objects over and above sense-data. Propositions about the physical world are to be reduced to propositions about mental experiences of perceivers, that is, phenomenological propositions.

Berkeley’s position can be clarified with an example. The proposition that the ball is red may be analyzed in terms of (and thus entails) propositions about the perceivers’ sensations, for example, that the ball appears red, spherical shaped, and so forth. Common sense propositions about the physical objects composing the external world are justified on the basis of an inductive inference from the propositions describing how things appear to perceivers that are entailed by the external world proposition. The ball’s being red is confirmed by the phenomenal or mental sensations of spherical redness that perceivers have. One’s having certain spherical and round sense-data confirms via induction the proposition that the ball is red which entails those sense-data.

The objection that Berkeley raises to Locke’s theory is a problem endemic to empiricism. It leaves open a gap that needs to be bridged to account for knowledge on the basis of the evidence of the senses. The gap to be explained is how sense-data, that is, propositions about one’s own mental states, justifies one’s beliefs in propositions about object in the external world. Berkeley avoids the problem of explaining the reason to think that one’s sensations resemble the real physical objects by adopting phenomenalism. In Berkeley’s metaphysics, Idealism, there are no non-phenomenal entities; physical objects are just the permanent possibility of sensation. The difference between sense-data that are veridical and non-veridical is that the veridical perceptions are sustained by God’s continuously having these sense-data in His mind. Thus, for Berkeley, the meaning of statements about physical objects may be captured by statements referring only to sense experience. In his theory physical objects just are reducible to sense-data. Berkeley proposes that God’s perceptions “hold” the physical universe together.

David Hume, the next luminary of British Empiricism, finds the dependence of epistemic justification on God’s perceptions to be unacceptable. Hume’s answer to the explanatory gap in Locke’s theory is that we naturally make the connection. One way of understanding Hume is by pointing to the fact that he adopts the view which in the 20^th century would become known as epistemology naturalized which relegates the explanation of the inference to science. Others have understood Hume as embracing skepticism with respect to the external world. Thomas Reid, Hume’s contemporary, invokes common sense to explain the inference. He argues that we have as good a reason to think that these common sense inferences are sufficient justification for knowledge as we have for thinking that deductive reasoning is sufficient justification for the derivation of knowledge.

Bertrand Russell rejects Berkley’s view that there are really no physical objects, but they are just bundles of perceptions. Russell accounts for perceptual knowledge claiming that we have direct access to sense-data, and these sense-data serve as the basis of empirical knowledge. Russell, in The Problems of Philosophy, admits that “in fact ‘knowledge’ is not a precise conception: it merges into ‘probable opinion’.” (Russell 1912 pg. 134).

C. I. Lewis (Lewis 1946) proposes a pragmatic version of phenomenalism to bridge the explanatory epistemological gap between sense-data and the external world. Lewis agrees with the British Empiricists that sense-data are what is ‘directly’ experienced and, moreover, serve as the given element in empirical knowledge. Berkeley’s phenomenalism attempts to bridge the explanatory gap with metaphysical Idealism. Lewis agrees with Russell that this is problematic. Lewis proposes a version of phenomenalism that is compatible with metaphysical Realism. On this view, external world propositions entail an infinite number of conditional propositions stating that if one initiates a certain type of actions (a test of the empirical proposition in question), then one experiences a certain type or sense-data. Thus, the explanatory gap is bridged by the rules of inductive inference.

Lewis’s example helps to explain his phenomenalistic account. Consider the external world proposition that there is a doorknob. Lewis claims that this proposition logically entails an unlimited number of conditional propositions expressing tests that could be undertaken to confirm that there really is a doorknob causing the experience. One such conditional would “if I were to appear to reach out in a certain way, I would have a sensation of grasping a doorknob shaped object.” One’s undertaking to appear to reach out and grab the doorknob, followed by the tactile experience of doorknob sense-data, provides confirmation, hence, pragmatic justification for believing the proposition that there is a doorknob. Thus, according to Lewis, the justification of empirical beliefs is based on an inductive interference, having confirmed sufficiently many such tests.

a. Chisholm’s Solution to the Problem of Empiricism

Chisholm enters the fray arguing (Chisholm 1948) that Lewis’s view is defective and thus fails to solve the problem of empiricism, that is, it cannot account for the inference from the mind to the external world. According to Lewis’s phenomenalism, statements about the external world, for example:

This is red;

entail propositions only referring to mental entities, sense-data, for example:

Redness will appear.

Chisholm argues that certain facts about perceptual relativity demonstrate that physical world propositions like P do not entail any propositions which refer exclusively to mental entities like R.

Chisholm explains that P, when conjoined with:

This is observed under normal conditions; and if this is red and observed under normal conditions, redness will appear;

entails R, that redness will appear. But P in conjunction with:

This is observed under normal conditions except for the presence of blue lights; and if this is red and observed under conditions which are normal except for the presence of blue lights, redness will not appear;

entails that R is false. If P and any other proposition that is consistent with P, for example S, entails that R is false, then P cannot entail Q. Perceptual relativity, the way that things appear in any circumstance being relative to the conditions under which the object is observed, makes it clear that S is consistent with P. However, P and S entail that redness will not appear, for red things do not appear red under blue light. Therefore, P does not entail R. Similarly, no physical object statement (like P) entails any proposition that is only about sense-data (like R). Chisholm concludes that Lewis’s phenomenalism is untenable.

The problem of empiricism, the justification of beliefs about physical objects based on perception, that Chisholm embarks on solving requires a plausible account of perceptual knowledge. The Lockean account claims that sense-data (mental ideas) justifies or makes evident beliefs about physical objects because sense-data resembles the physical objects. agreement of ideas. However, on Locke’s account we can never “get outside” the mind to observe the resemblance between the sense-data and the physical object causing them. Thus, it fails to provide the requisite reason for thinking that physical objects resemble the mental images. Phenomenalism proposes to avoid this problem by claiming that propositions about physical objects entail purely psychological propositions about apparent experience, sense-data. Thus, inductive reasoning (or the hypothetico-deductive method) from the psychological propositions could provide justification for the physical proposition they entail; thereby, justifying beliefs about the physical object.

But, Chisholm argues, propositions about physical objects do not entail any purely psychological propositions, that is, phenomenalism is false. Thus, if empiricism is to be salvaged, there must be another account or explanation of how propositions about appearances provide evidence that justifies beliefs about the physical world. Chisholm answers this problem with his account of the Indirectly Evident.

b. Epistemic Principles—Perception and Memory, Confirmation and Concurrence

Chisholm adopts three methodological assumptions in developing his epistemic principles or rules of evidence to account for empirical knowledge:

• We know, more or less, what (upon reflection) we think we know (an anti-skeptical assumption);
• On occasions when we do have knowledge, we can know what justifies us in believing what we know;
• There are general principles of evidence that can be formulated to capture the conditions which need to be satisfied by these things that we know.

Carneades of Cyrene (ca.213-129 B.C.E.), the Ancient Greek Academic Skeptic who was a successor to Plato as the leader of the Academy, developed three skeptical epistemic principles to explain the justification that perception provides for beliefs about the external world. On Carneades’ view, while ‘perceiving’ something to be a cat is not sufficient for knowing that there is a cat, nonetheless, it makes the proposition that there is a cat acceptable. While disagreeing with Carneades’ skeptical conclusion, Chisholm thinks that Carneades’ approach to developing epistemic principles is correct.

Chisholm formulates Carneades’ first epistemic principle related to perception as:

C1.	“Having a perception of something being F tends to make acceptable the proposition that something is an F.” (Chisholm 1977 pg. 68).

Having identified these acceptable propositions, Carneades notes that the set of perceptual propositions that are “hanging together like the links of a chain”, and which are “uncontradicted and concurring” (Chisholm 1977 pg. 69), including the perceptions of color, shape, and size, are also acceptable. The concurrence of these propositions makes all of them acceptable, hence his second principle

C2.	Confirmed propositions that concur and do not contradict each other are more reasonable than those that do not.

Finally, the acceptable propositions that remain after close scrutiny and testing are even more reasonable than merely acceptable. This is captured in a third epistemic principle:

C3.	“Concurrent propositions that survive ‘close scrutiny and test’ are more reasonable than those that do not.” (Chisholm 1977 pg. 70).

Pyrrho, Carneades’ Ancient Greek skeptic predecessor, believed that our common sense beliefs about the world were completely irrational and thus irrational to act upon. This extreme form of skepticism on its face is unacceptable to most; for example, people in general do not try to walk off cliffs nor think that doing so would be rational. Carneades’ approach to epistemology and his development of principles explaining how our beliefs are rational or acceptable, but not knowledge, by contrast, seems intuitively plausible. Thus, Chisholm adopts Carneades’ common sense approach in developing his account of the indirectly evident.

Chisholm points out that there are three possible ways in which the indirectly evident may be justified:

1. By the relationship they bear to what is directly evident;
2. By the relationship they bear to each other; and
3. By their own nature, independent of any relationship they bear to anything else.

He notes that theories that account for the justification of beliefs in this first way is considered foundationalist, and that ones that account for justification of beliefs in the second way is coherentism or a coherence theory. Chisholm claims that the indirectly evident is justified in all three ways. This is consistent with his view that focusing on the ‘isms’ is not conducive to solving philosophical problems.

Chisholm claims that just about every indirectly evident proposition is justified, at least in part, by some relationship it bears to the foundation of empirical knowledge, to the directly evident. The foundation cannot serve as justification for knowing anything unless we are justified in believing these propositions. To remind us of how the directly evident is justified, Chisholm presents the following epistemic principle

(A)	S’s being F is such that, if it occurs, then it is self-presenting to S that he is F. (Chisholm 1977 pg. 73).

The epistemic principles are formulated as schemata, that is, abbreviations for infinitely many principles. In (A), ‘F’ may be replaced by any predicate that would be picked from “a list of various predicates, each of such a sort as to yield a description of a self-presenting state of S.” (Chisholm 1977 pg. 73). This principle asserts that, for example, if I am appeared redly to, then it is self-presenting to me that I am appeared redly to. Moreover, whenever I am in such a state, for example, the state of being am appeared redly to, the proposition that I am appeared to redly is evident, directly evident, for me.

Chisholm’s next two epistemic principles concern perception. These principles are intended to show how the indirectly evident is justified by the combination of their relationship to the foundation and by their own nature, that is, the nature of perception and memory. Some clarification of the terminology used in these principles will aid in understanding the theory. Chisholm uses ‘believes he/she perceives that’ to assert a relationship between a person and a proposition, for example, that Jones believes that she perceives that there is a cat. This can be true even when it is false that there is a cat in front of her, for example, even when she is hallucinating. An alternative way Chisholm sometimes expresses this is as ‘Jones takes there to be a cat’. Chisholm prefers to use ‘believes that she perceives’ in place of ‘takes’ as it makes the ‘that’-clause explicit, noting that we will assume that ‘believes that she perceives’ means simply that the person has a spontaneous nonreflective experience, one that she would normally express by saying, “I perceive that…”.

Chisholm observes that, to account for the justification of perceptual propositions, one might be inclined (as he was in the first edition of Theory of Knowledge) to formulate a principle along the line of Carneades’ first epistemic principle that if a person believes that he perceives that there is a sheep, then the person is justified in believing that there is a sheep.

However, such a principle must be qualified because of cases like the following. Suppose that a person seems to see an animal that looks like a sheep, but also knows that (i) there are no sheep in the area, and (ii) many dogs in the area look like sheep. Contrary to what this principle implies, the person is not justified in believing that it is a sheep (but rather a dog).

Chisholm qualifies this principle to exclude cases like this one because the person has grounds for doubt that the proposition in question. To qualify this principle he defines a term, ground for doubt, which in turn depends on having no conjunction of propositions that are both acceptable for the person which tend to confirm that the proposition in question is false.

Chisholm defines the requisite notion of confirmation as

D4.1	e tends to confirm h =Df Necessarily, for every S, if e is evident for S and if everything that is evident for S is entailed by e, then h has some presumption in its favor for s.

He explains that confirmation is both a logical and an epistemic relation. If it obtains between two propositions, that is, if e confirms h, then necessarily it obtains between these two propositions (it is a matter of logic that it obtains). Furthermore, if e confirms h, and if one knew that e was true, one would also have reason for thinking that h was true. Chisholm cautions that from the fact that e confirms h, it does not follow that the conjunction e and another proposition, g, also confirms h. What we assert in saying that e confirms h may also be expressed by saying that h has a certain (high) probability in relation to e.

Armed with this concept notion of confirmation, he now defines what is it for something to be believed without ground for doubt as≔=

D4.3	S believes, without ground for doubt, that p =Df (i) S believes that p, and (ii) no conjunction of propositions that are acceptable for S tends to confirm the negation of the proposition that p. (Chisholm 1977 pg. 76)

Chisholm qualifies the epistemic principle under consideration as:

(B)	For any subject S, if S believes without ground for doubt that he perceives something to be F, then it is beyond reasonable doubt for S that he perceives something to be F. (Chisholm 1977 pg. 76).

While this principle justifies beliefs about the external world to a higher degree than did Carneades’ principle, it falls short of rendering them sufficiently justified for knowledge. Chisholm’s reason for this is that the property designated in the schema by F can be replaced by a property like being a sheep about which the person may have mistakenly classified the object he is looking at.

Chisholm proposes a third epistemic principle which yields knowledge level justification of propositions by restricting the properties that one is perceiving the object to have to the ‘proper objects’ of perception. These are sensible characteristics, such as visual characteristics like colors and shapes, auditory characteristics like loud and soft, tactile characteristics like smooth and rough, olfactory characteristics like spicy and burn, gustatory characteristics like salty and sweet, and ‘common sensibles’ like movement and number. This principle states:

(C)	For any subject S and any sensible characteristic F, if S believes, without ground for doubt, that he is perceiving something to be F, then it is evident for S that he perceives something to be F. (Chisholm 1977 pg. 78)

This principle accounts for justifying the indirectly evident on the basis of the directly evident. Consider how it works in a case that Jones is looking at a red object. Assume that she is appeared to redly (the object appears to her to be red) and that she has no evidence that would count against her actually perceiving that there is something red (that is, that nothing acceptable to her that tends to confirm that she is not actually perceiving something to be red). In such a case it is evident to her that (i) she actually perceives something to be red, and (ii) that there is something red. Moreover, she knows those propositions assuming that she believes them.

These epistemic principles account only for the justification of our beliefs concerning what we are perceiving at any given moment. To account for the justification of anything about the past, Chisholm proposes epistemic principles to account for the justification of beliefs based on memory. We should note that “’memory’ presents us with a terminological difficulty analogous to that presented by ‘perception’.“ (Chisholm 1977 pg. 79). Chisholm proposes that the expression ‘believes that he remembers’ be used in a way analogous to the way he uses ‘believes that he perceives’; that is, ‘S believes that he remembers that p’ does not imply the truth of p (nor does it imply that p is false).

Chisholm notes that “[s]ince both our memory and perception can play us false, we run a twofold risk when we appeal to the memory of a perception.” (Chisholm 1977 pg. 79). If we are justified in believing a proposition based on our seeming to remember that we perceived it to be true, we can go wrong in two ways: our perception or our memory (or possibly both) may mislead us. For this reason, Chisholm formulates principles for remembering that we perceived, principles along the same lines as the principles concerning perception but takes into account that the evidence that memory of a perception provides is weaker than that of perception. The principles about memory of perceptions, therefore, only justify propositions to a lower epistemic level of justification than those of perception. Corresponding to (B), Chisholm proposes:

(D) For any subject S, if S believes, without ground for doubt, that he remembers perceiving something to be F, then the proposition that he does remember perceiving something to be F is one that is acceptable for S. (Chisholm 1977 pg. 80).

Restricting the range of ‘F’ to sensible predicates, he presents the following analogue to (C):

(E)     For any subject S, if S believes, without ground for doubt, that he remembers perceiving something to be F, then it is beyond a reasonable doubt for S that he does remember perceiving something to be F. (Chisholm 1977 pg. 80).

Chisholm points out that if our memory of perceptions is reasonable, then so must our memory of self-presenting states, and thus, proposes that:

(F)     For any subject S and any self-presenting property F, if S believes, without ground for doubt, that he remembers being F, then it is beyond a reasonable doubt for S that he remembers that he was F. (Chisholm 1977 pg. 81).

Although Chisholm explained the justification of some empirical beliefs, the epistemic principles presented thus far do not account for knowledge of ordinary common-sense propositions (for example, ‘There is a cat on the roof’). The epistemic principles proposed to this point account for these propositions being acceptable or beyond reasonable doubt, but do not account for their being evident, that is, justified to the level required for knowledge.

Chisholm appeals to the coherence of propositions about memory and perception, that is, their being mutually confirming and concurring, to explain how beliefs can be justified to the level required for knowledge. A proposition justified to a certain level is also justified to all lower levels, for example, an evident proposition, is also beyond a reasonable doubt, acceptable, and has some presumption in its favor. Some propositions justified according to the epistemic principles of perception and memory are evident, others beyond reasonable doubt, and others as acceptable, but all propositions justified by these principles are at least acceptable.

Chisholm proposes that if the conjunction of all propositions that are acceptable for someone tend to confirm another proposition, then this latter proposition has some presumption in its favor, that is:

(G)    If the conjunction of all those propositions e, such that e is acceptable for S at t tends to confirm h, then h has some presumption in its favor for S at t. (Chisholm 1977 pp. 82-83).

He then defines the concept of a concurrent set of propositions, which may be thought of as coherence of propositions or beliefs, as follows:

D4.4   A is a set of concurrent propositions =Df A is a set of two or more propositions each of which is such that the conjunction of all the others tends to confirm it and is logically independent of it. (Chisholm 1977 pg. 83).

He proposes the following, somewhat bold, epistemic principle of how concurring proposition raise their level of epistemic justification:

(H)      Any set of concurring propositions, each of which has some presumption in its favor for S, is such that each of its members is beyond reasonable doubt for S.

To explain how this principle works, Chisholm asks us to consider the following propositions:

1. 1. There is a cat on the roof today;
   2. There was a cat on the roof yesterday;
   3. There was a cat on the roof the day before yesterday;
   4. There is a cat on the roof almost every day.

He asks us to suppose that (1) expresses a perceptual belief and, therefore, is beyond reasonable doubt; (2) and (3) express what I seem to remember perceiving, and thus, are acceptable; and (4) is confirmed by the conjunction of these acceptable statements. As this set of propositions is concurrent, each is beyond reasonable doubt (according to (H)).

Chisholm completes his theory of evidence by accounting for our knowledge which is gained via perception with the following principle:

(I)    If S believes, without ground for doubt, that he perceives something to be F, and if the proposition that there is something F is a member of a set of concurrent propositions each of which is beyond reasonable doubt for S, then it is evident for S that he perceives something to be F. (Chisholm 1977 pg. 84).

This completes the account that Chisholm promised of how the Indirectly Evident may be justified in three ways. The first is, at least partially, by its relationship to the foundation. The epistemic principles accounting for justification of propositions based on perception and memory are partially dependent on the self-presenting states of being appeared to in a certain way, that is, seeming to perceive and seeming to remember perceiving. The second is that they provide justification because of their own nature, that is, that perception and memory provide prima facie evidence for believing that they represent the way things are in the world. The third is that by the coherence, the confirmation and concurrence, of propositions that are justified to a lower level than required by knowledge. Chisholm’s account is not only a version of foundationalism, but also incorporates elements of the coherence theory.

Chisholm admits that these epistemic principles provide, at best, an outline of a full-blown account of our knowledge of the external world, and a very rough one at that. They do not give an account of our knowledge of many of the very common things that we know about the past and about the complex world that we live in. However, this was all that Chisholm promised to provide. Moreover, this account is one of the most complete and comprehensive accounts developed of empirical knowledge.

7. Postscript

This presentation of Chisholm’s epistemology is largely based on the version of his theory from the second edition of his book Theory of Knowledge (Chisholm 1977). Chisholm continuously revised and improved his theory based on counterexamples and objections raised by his colleagues and students. His subsequent works provided his answers to the Gettier Problem, as well as a more detailed account of the epistemic principles accounting for the Indirectly Evident. In 1989 Chisholm published his third, and what became his final, edition of his Theory of Knowledge. This article is intended to introduce Chisholm’s theory of knowledge to lay the groundwork for the reader to undertake a detailed examination of the final version of his theory. It is left as an exercise to the reader to decide whether Chisholm’s principles do what he intends them to do.

8. References and Further Reading

• Ayer, A. J., 1940. The Foundations of Empirical Knowledge, New York, NY: St. Martins Press.
• Berkeley, George, 1710. The Principles of Human Knowledge, (http://www.earlymoderntexts.com/assets/pdfs/berkeley1710.pdf)
• Chisholm Roderick, 1942, “The Problem of the Speckled Hen,” Mind 51(204): 368-373.
• Chisholm, Roderick, 1946, Monograph: “Theory of Knowledge” in Roderick M. Chisholm, Herbert Feigl, William H. Frankena, John Passmore, and Manley Thomson (eds.), Philosophy: The Princeton Studies: Humanistic Scholarship in America, 233-344, reprinted in Chisholm 1982.
• Chisholm, Roderick, 1948. “The Problem of Empiricism,” The Journal of Philosophy 45, 512-517.
• Chisholm, Roderick, 1957. Perceiving: A Philosophical Study, Ithaca: Cornell University Press.
• Chisholm, Roderick, 1965. “‘Appear’, ‘Take’, and ‘Know’”, reprinted in Robert J. Swartz (ed.), Perceiving, Sensing, and Knowing, (University of California, Berkeley, California, 1965).
• Chisholm, Roderick, 1966. Theory of Knowledge, Englewood Cliffs, NJ: Prentice-Hall.
• Chisholm, Roderick, 1977. Theory of Knowledge, 2nd edition. Englewood Cliffs, NJ: Prentice-Hall.
• Chisholm, Roderick, 1979. “The Directly Evident,” in George Pappas (ed.), Justification and Knowledge, Dordrecht, D. Reidel Publishing Co.
• Chisholm, Roderick, 1982. The Foundations of Knowing, Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press.
• Chisholm, Roderick, 1989. Theory of Knowledge, 3rd edition. Englewood Cliffs, NJ: Prentice-Hall.
• Chudnoff, Elijah, 2021. Forming Impressions: Expertise in Perception and Intuition, Oxford, Oxford University Press.
• Clifford, W. K., 1877. “The Ethics of Belief”, Contemporary Review (177), reprinted in Clifford’s Lectures and Essays (London, MacMillan, 1879).
• Conee, Earl and Feldman, Richard, 2011. Evidentialism: Essays in Epistemology, Oxford, Oxford University Press.
• Descartes, Rene, 1641, Meditations on First Philosophy (Third Edition), edited by Donald J. Cress, Indianapolis, IN, Hackett Publishing Company, 1993.
• Feldman, Richard, 1974. “An Alleged Defect in Gettier-Counterexamples,” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 52(1), 68-69.
• Feldman, Richard, 2003. Epistemology, Upper Saddle River, NJ, Prentice Hall.
• Foley, R., 1997. “Chisholm’s Epistemic Principles,” in Hahn 1997, pp. 241–264.
• Gettier, Edmund, 1963. “Is Knowledge Justified True Belief?” Analysis 23, 121-123.
• Goldman, Alvin, 1976. “A Causal Theory of Knowing.” Journal of Philosophy, 64, 357-372.
• Hahn, Lewis Edwin 1997. The Philosophy of Roderick M. Chisholm, (The Library of Living Philosophers: Volume 25), Lewis Edwin Hahn (ed.), Chicago, La Salle: Open Court.
• Heidelberger, H., 1969. “Chisholm’s Epistemic Principles,” Noûs, 3(1), 73–82.
• Hume, David, A Treatise of Human Nature, (London, Oxford Clarendon Press, 1973).
• Hume, David, Enquiries Concerning Human Understanding and Concerning the Principles of Morals (3^rd Edition), (London, Oxford Clarendon Press, 1976).
• James, William, 1896. “The Will to Believe”, in The Will to Believe, and Other Essays in Popular Philosophy, and Human Immortality, New York, Dover Publications, 1960.
• Kyburg, Henry E. Jr., 1970. “On a Certain Form of Philosophical Argument,” American Philosophical Quarterly, 7,  229-237.
• Legum, Richard A. 1980. “Probability and Foundationalism: Another Look at the Lewis-Reichenbach Debate.” Philosophical Studies 38(4), 419–425.
• Lehrer, Keith, 1997, “The Quest for the Evident” in Hahn 1997, pp. 387–401.
• Leibniz, Gottfreid Wilhelm, 1705, New Essays Concerning Human Understanding, (LaSalle, Il: Open Court Publishing Company, 1916), http://www.earlymoderntexts.com/assets/pdfs/leibniz1705book4.pdf.
• Lewis, C.I., 1929. Mind and the World Order. New York, Dover Publications.
• Lewis, C.I., 1946. An Analysis of Knowledge and Valuation. La Salle, IL, Open Court.
• Lewis, C.I., 1952. “The Given Element in Empirical Knowledge.” The Philosophical Review 61, 168-175.
• Locke, John, 1690, An Essay Concerning Human Understanding, edited by Peter H. Niddich (Clarendon Press; 1st Clarendon edition (2 Aug. 1979)).
• Mavrodes George, 1973. “James and Clifford on ‘The Will to Believe’,” in Keith Yandell (ed.), God, Man, and Religion (McGraw-Hill, New York, 1973).
• Pollock, J and Cruz, J. 1999. Contemporary Theories of Knowledge, 2^nd edition. New York, Rowman & Littlefield.
• Pryor, J. 2001. “Highlights of Recent Epistemology,” The British Journal for the Philosophy of Science 52, 95-124. (Stresses that modest foundationalism looks better in 2001 than it looked ca. 1976).
• Quine. W.V.O. 1951. “Two Dogmas of Empiricism.” The Philosophical Review 60, 20-43.
• Reichenbach, Hans, 1952. “Are Phenomenal Reports Absolutely Certain.” The Philosophical Review 61, 168-175.
• Russell, Bertrand, 1912, The Problems of Philosophy, Hackett Publishing Company, Indianapolis.
• Sellars, Wilfred, 1956, “Empiricism and the Philosophy of Mind,” in H. Feig l and M. Scriven, Minnesota Studies in the Philosophy of Science, Vol. I, (Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press, 1956), pp. 253-329.
• Sosa, Ernest, 1980. “The Raft and The Pyramid: Coherence versus Foundations in the Theory of Knowledge,” in French, Uehling, and Wettstein (eds.), Midwest Studies in Philosophy, Volume V, Studies in Epistemology, (University of Minnesota Press, Minneapolis, 1980).
• Sosa, Ernest, 1997, “Chisholm’s Epistemology and Epistemic Internalism,” in The Philosophy of Roderick M. Chisholm (The Library of Living Philosophers: Volume 25), Lewis Edwin Hahn (ed.), Chicago, La Salle, Open Court, pp. 267–287.
• van Cleve, James. 1977. “Probability and Certainty: A Reexamination of the Lewis-Reichenbach Debate’,” Philosophical Studies 32(4), 323-34.
• van Cleve, James. 2005. “Why Coherence is Not Enough: A Defense of Moderate Foundationalism,” in Contemporary Debates in Epistemology, edited by Matthias Steup and Ernest Sosa. Oxford, Blackwell, pp. 168-80.
• Vogel, Jonathan. 1990. “Cartesian Skepticism and Inference to the Best Explanation.” The Journal of Philosophy 87, 658-666.

 

Author Information

Richard Legum
Email: richard.legum@kbcc.cuny.edu
City University of New York
U. S. A.

Doxastic Conservatism

We are creatures with clear cognitive limitations. Our memories are finite and there is a limit to the kinds of things we can store and retrieve. We cannot, for example, remember the justification or evidence for many of our beliefs. Moreover, in response to our limited cognitive resources, we generally tend to maintain our beliefs and are reluctant to change them. A clear case of this psychological tendency to preserve beliefs obtains when people are informed of the inadequacy of the original grounds of their beliefs. Their reluctance to change their beliefs shows that they are sensitive to the fact that changing them incurs cognitive costs, thus straining their limited resources.

Certain views in epistemology have sought to put a rational gloss on this phenomenon of belief perseverance by suggesting the thesis of doxastic conservatism, according to which the fact that one believes a proposition provides some measure of justification for that belief. This initial picture has, however, become more complicated by further claims made on behalf of the thesis to the effect that it also has the potential to resolve certain outstanding problems in epistemology, (such as how perception is a source of reason), skeptical worries about induction, and the problem of easy knowledge. Examination of these claims reveals that they involve more than one thesis of conservatism. Moreover, it appears that the epistemic role that is attributed to the conservative thesis is often played by superficially similar claims which derive their epistemic significance not from what the thesis regards as the source of justification but from other substantial properties that are attributed to beliefs. This article presents and examines some of the main accounts of the thesis of doxastic conservatism as well as the arguments that are suggested in their support.

Table of Contents

1. Doxastic Conservatism: The Debate
2. Varieties of Doxastic Conservatism
3. Differential Conservatism
4. Perseverance Conservatism
5. Generation Conservatism
   1. Arguing for and Against GC
      1. The Transcendental Argument
      2. The Argument from Charity
   2. Modifying GC
      1. Conservatism as the Principle of Credulity
      2. Conservatism as Believing in the Absence of Defeaters
      3. Conservatism as a Dynamic Strategy
6. Conclusion
7. References and Further Reading

1. Doxastic Conservatism: The Debate

Doxastic conservatism refers to a variety of theses which, in different ways, emphasize the stability of one’s belief system by requiring the subject to refrain from revising his or her beliefs when there are no good reasons for a revision. We are all too familiar with the fact that our undeniable cognitive limitations restrict the set of things we can store or retrieve. Often, we lose track of the justification relations among our beliefs and the reasons behind them, which is why, as well documented experiments have shown, we tend to retain many of our beliefs despite being informed of the inadequacy of their original grounds. Against this background of limited cognitive resources and the costs that the changing of one’s mind incurs, doxastic conservatism (DC) presents itself as a viable blueprint for regulating our belief-forming processes by recommending the adoption of those hypotheses that minimize the revision of our belief system, thereby ensuring its stability. The advocates of DC, however, do not limit its virtues to the minimization of such cognitive costs; they sometimes make ambitious claims on its behalf, highlighting its ability to serve a number of epistemological projects such as the justification of memory beliefs and the resolution of various skeptical problems (McGrath 2007, McCain 2008, and Poston 2012).

However, before proceeding to delineate the contours of the conservatism thesis as well as its purported virtues, an important terminological remark is in order. The conservative thesis that is the subject of this article is generally known in the literature under the rubric of epistemic conservatism. However, since there are several different theses in epistemology all using the same or a similar label, it is best to call it doxastic rather than epistemic conservatism to distinguish it from such theses as phenomenal conservatism and epistemic conservatism, the latter of which is found in the context of the liberalism (dogmatism)/conservatism debate. According to phenomenal conservatism (Huemer 2001), if it seems to you that p, then, in the absence of defeaters, you thereby have at least some degree of justification for believing p. When phenomenal conservatism is restricted to perceptual experience, the thesis is known as dogmatism (Pryor 2000). According to dogmatism (liberalism), perceptual experience (e) gives one justification to believe its content if it appears to one that p and one has no reason to suspect that any skeptical alternative to p is true. So, in this liberal theory, experience on its own can confer justification on the belief in its content. Against this liberal view stands the conservative view, notably defended by Crispin Wright (2004), according to which to be warranted or justified in holding a perceptual belief, we must have some antecedent justification or entitlement to believe certain fundamental presuppositions such as the existence of the world, the reliability of our perceptual system, and so on. With this word of caution out of the way, discussion of conservatism can proceed without the risk of confusing it with similarly labeled doctrines.

Doxastic conservatism has informed philosophical views as diverse as Quine’s and Chisholm’s. According to Quine (1951), belief revision must be subject to a number of conditions, most notably the overall simplicity of the resulting belief system and the need to preserve as many earlier beliefs as possible. For Chisholm (1980), however, conservative principles play an important role in his defense of epistemological foundationalism. Despite the popularity of the conservatism thesis, however, it is difficult to identify a single thesis as representing its content. Sometimes DC is presented as the claim that the holding of a belief confers some positive epistemic status on its content, sometimes it is said to regulate our decision to continue to hold a belief, and sometimes it is said to help us to decide between a number of evidentially equivalent alternative hypotheses. Although it is easy to see a common motivation behind all these different versions of DC, one should not lose sight of their differences, because the considerations that are usually offered in their defense often involve different concerns. This article begins by distinguishing between three main varieties of doxastic conservatism, namely, differential, perseverance, and generation conservatism. It then examines the plausibility of the arguments given in their support. This investigation pays special attention to the alleged payoffs of DC. In particular, it will inquire whether it is DC, on its own, that has such epistemic potentials or whether the latter are the result of other claims that superficially resemble DC.

2. Varieties of Doxastic Conservatism

As noted above, the thesis of doxastic conservatism actually covers a family of views that are all presented as conservative theses. These non-equivalent versions of conservatism differ from each other not only because their advocates often reject one version while upholding another, but also because the arguments that are put forward in their favor are actually tailored to defend one particular version to the exclusion of another. For example, Lawrence Sklar (1975) defends what he calls methodological conservatism, which guides a cognizer who comes to know of a hypothesis that is evidentially equivalent to the one that she has already adopted. However, Sklar rejects another version of conservatism, according to which holding a belief confers some measure of justification on that belief, for being too strong. It is, however, this latter version of conservatism, defended by Chisholm (1980), that is upheld as the standard version of doxastic conservatism.

Another exponent of conservatism, Gilbert Harman (1986), is more concerned with uncovering the principles that regulate our continuing to believe a proposition in the absence of contrary reasons. Although Harman sometimes appeals to the standard version of conservatism, on his official account conservatism is the view according to which “one is justified in continuing fully to accept something in the absence of a special reason not to” (1986, p. 46). Accordingly, to evaluate the thesis of epistemic conservatism, it would be more appropriate to begin by distinguishing the following types of the conservative theses (Vahid 2004):

Differential Conservatism (DiC)	One is justified in holding to a hypothesis (belief) despite coming to know of evidentially equivalent alternatives.
Perseverance Conservatism (PC)	One is justified to continue to hold a belief as long as there is no special reason to give it up.
Generation Conservatism (GC)	Holding a belief confers some measure of justification on the belief.

When evaluating these theses for their epistemic worth, it should be borne in mind that some of the virtues mentioned in connection with their plausibility are pragmatic in nature. We are told that, due to our cognitive limitations, changing our mind for no good reason is a waste of our time, energy, and resources, and that, therefore, following the conservative principles would minimize such costs and save us from dwindling our resources. Whatever the practical merits of conservatism, such virtues, on their own, due to their pragmatic nature, fail to ensure that epistemically warranted beliefs would result from adherence to the conservative principles as canons of theory choice. Thus, we need to see what it is exactly that makes conservatism an epistemic, rather than a pragmatic, thesis, and this is best achieved by examining the merits of each conservative principle on its own.

3. Differential Conservatism

According to Sklar, “[a]ll [differential conservatism] commits us to is the decision not to reject a hypothesis once believed simply because we become aware of alternative, incompatible hypotheses which are just as good as, but no better than, that believed” (1975, 378). Sklar’s defense of DiC is a sort of transcendental argument involving what he calls an anti-foundationalist “local theory of justification.” Unlike the foundationalist theory of justification, in which basic beliefs depend on no other beliefs for their justification, the local theory takes epistemic justification to be relative to a body of assumed, unchallenged background beliefs. These background beliefs are supposed to play the role of evidence. They can play such a role, says Sklar, because their own status is not at the time under scrutiny. Such an account, however, is consistent with the existence of incompatible total belief structures all being locally justified. The only way to rule out this possibility is to invoke differential conservatism and hold on to what we already believe despite becoming aware of competing belief structures.

This argument, however, leaves one with a lacuna about the status of the background beliefs in the relevant belief structures. In order to confer justification on the target belief, these background beliefs must themselves be justified. However, with Sklar’s rejection of foundationalism, such beliefs can only acquire their epistemic worth either by cohering with the rest of one’s belief system or by relying on GC, according to which the mere holding of a belief confers a positive epistemic status on it. The latter option is not available to Sklar because he rejects GC for being too strong. The only alternative seems to be to adopt a coherence theory of justification and claim that the unchallenged background beliefs acquire their justified status by belonging to a coherent belief system. Collapsing the local theory into a holistic coherence theory of justification, though, renders DiC redundant. It is indeed no accident that, in defending the local theory, Sklar is forced to respond to the alternative coherent systems objection that usually arises for the coherentist accounts of justification. Either way, the transcendental argument is unsuccessful.

Considering the following scenario highlights another problem with DiC. Suppose two subjects, S₁ and S₂, faced with the task of explaining some body of data (e), come up with two incompatible hypotheses, H₁ and H₂ respectively, that can equally account for e. Both can be said to be justified in believing their respective hypothesis. Suppose, however, that S₂ also learns or independently discovers that H₁ equally accounts for e, and for some non-evidential, perhaps aesthetic, reason gives up his previous belief and instead comes to believe that H₁. By DiC, S₂ should have stuck with H₂ and his belief that H₁ is therefore not justified. If so, we have a case here where two tokens of the same belief (H₁) are based on the same grounds, but while one is justified, the other is not, and this undermines the thesis of epistemic supervenience according to which the justification of a belief supervenes on certain non-epistemic properties of that belief, such as being reliably produced, being adequately grounded, or being part of a coherent belief system. It is worth noting that this problem only affects DiC on non-permissivist views according to which, for any body of evidence e and any proposition p, there is at most one kind of doxastic attitude towards p that is permitted by e.

One might object that since e equally justifies both H₁ and H₂, and the two hypotheses cohere equally well with S₂’s beliefs, S₂ is neither justified in believing H₁ nor justified in believing H₂ (McCain 2008). Of course, with these further stipulations about the justificatory role of coherence and the strength of evidence, S₂ will not be justified. This would be a different conservative thesis (see below for discussion), however, and not the thesis that Sklar defends, which clearly states that one can retain one’s justification for believing a hypothesis despite coming to know of incompatible but evidentially equivalent hypotheses.

Finally, DiC may lack intuitive plausibility. Suppose a subject S comes to believe that H₁ on the ground that it explains some data e. It is plausible to think that S’s awareness of a competing but equally explanatory hypothesis H₂ should require some doxastic attitude adjustment vis-à-vis her belief that H₁. The thought is that by finding out that H₂ equally accounts for e and that H₁ and H₂ cannot be both correct, S, being a rational agent, should conclude that she may have assessed e inappropriately. Of course, this does not mean that S’s belief that H₁ is false. However, given her fallibility, awareness of the second-order evidence regarding the possibility of her inappropriate assessment of e should prompt S to be more circumspect in her attitude towards H₁. It follows that the rational credibility of this belief is thereby eroded to some extent. If S continues to come across further competing explanations of e such as H₃, H₄, and so forth, the evidential impact of such collective evidence would become quite impressive to the extent of significantly undermining the epistemic status of S’s original belief that H₁. This conclusion is clearly at odds with DiC’s recommendation that S ought to stick with H₁ regardless of the competing hypotheses that she may come across.

Marc Moffett (2007) has argued, however, that awareness of competing but equally explanatory hypotheses—underdetermination—does not constitute a defeater for holding on to our beliefs if we help ourselves with something like GC. In other words, if we accept that merely having a belief constitutes a prima facie justification for that belief, then it follows that if one believes that p at t, one should not abandon this belief at t unless one has adequate reason to do so. Accordingly, Moffett denies that knowledge that one’s belief is rationally underdetermined by evidence undermines our entitlement to that belief, for, given that underdetermination is a widespread phenomenon, we would be forced to adopt a theoretically neutral psychological standpoint in a great portion of our cognitive endeavors, which is implausible. Apart from the problem that this maneuver is at odds with Sklar’s rejection of GC, it is unclear whether such considerations constitute epistemic, rather than prudential or moral, reasons for holding on to beliefs.

4. Perseverance Conservatism

The driving force behind this version of conservatism, defended most notably by Harman (1986), has been the phenomenon of “lost justification” or “lost evidence.” As noted before, failure to keep track of our evidence, itself the result of our cognitive limitations, is usually taken to explain the so-called phenomenon of “belief perseverance in the face of evidential discrediting.” Experimental results have shown that people exhibit a psychological tendency towards the perseverance of their beliefs when apprised of the unreliability of the original source of those beliefs because they fail to recall that it was the discredited evidence that was initially responsible for their beliefs.

Harman discerns two competing theories of the rationality of belief perseverance, the foundations theory and the coherence theory. The former requires that one have a special reason to continue to hold a particular belief if one is to be justified in that belief, while the latter, by contrast, only requires the absence of any special reason to revise the belief in question for one to be justified to continue to hold it. Since the foundations theory requires that one keep track of one’s original reasons, Harman concludes that, in the face of the phenomenon of lost evidence, it is the coherence theory that is normatively correct, and the conservative thesis is simply the expression of its normative import. Although Harman sometimes understands conservatism as the thesis that “a proposition can acquire justification simply by being believed” (1986, p.30), it is obvious that it is not GC that he has in mind. For if having a bare belief is to be sufficient for its justification, the phenomenon of lost evidence or justification would be rendered impossible since the belief itself would ground its justification.

Harman’s official account of conservatism, along the lines of PC, maintains that one is justified in continuing to hold a belief as long as there are no good reasons against it. Although PC can account for the rationality of belief perseverance, alternative explanations of such rationality can undermine its credibility. Before addressing this issue, it is worth considering an objection made to Harman’s argument from lost justification by David Christensen (1994), as it would further clarify what PC really involves. Christensen thinks that one can explain the phenomenon of belief perseverance without appealing to any conservative principle. Suppose, for example, that I currently hold the belief that the population of India exceeds that of the United States, though I have forgotten what the source of my belief was. To show that conservatism need not play any role in explaining the rationality of this belief, Christensen offers what he takes to be a similar case, where it is completely implausible to invoke any conservative principle. Suppose I flip a coin which lands out of my sight, and I decide to believe that it has landed tails up without checking to see whether it has. It is obviously implausible to take that belief as justified, but it seems this is what conservatism invites us to do.

Despite their structural similarity, the two cases, says Christensen, differ in the following respect: “In both cases, I have a belief for which I am unable to cite any grounds…Yet in one case, maintaining the belief seems quite reasonable; while in the other… unreasonable” (1994, 74). Christensen claims that one cannot explain this difference in terms of the applicability of conservatism in one case and its inapplicability in another. Rather, it is to be explained by the role that background beliefs play in the two cases. In the India example, I have some background beliefs—for example, that I have acquired the belief from a reliable source, that despite India and the United States being favorite topics in my family, I have never been contradicted, and so forth—that convince me that my belief is correct. Moreover, it is precisely such beliefs that maintain the rationality of my continuing to hold the belief about India’s population. However, no similar beliefs are present in the coin example, which is why I am not justified in holding the belief that I do.

Vahid has, however, criticized this argument on several grounds (2004). It could be, for instance, that the coin example and the India example are only superficially similar. It is true that, in both cases, I have a belief for which I can no longer recall any evidence, but this is true for different reasons in the two cases. In the India case, I have forgotten the original source of my belief, but in the coin case there is simply no reason to report. So the coin case is not really an instance of the phenomenon of forgotten evidence. More damaging, even the India example does not seem to be a case of forgotten evidence. For what seems to be forgotten in that example is merely the name or identity of the source of my belief, and that is irrelevant to the question of the rationality of continuing to hold to that belief. After all, Christensen himself maintains that among the things I know in this case is that “I was once told [about India’s population] by… some… reliable source, and I (quite rationally) accepted the source’s word for it” (1994, p.73). To put it differently, the evidence that I have forgotten in this example concerns the identity of the source of my belief that India is more populous than the United States. However, as far the belief itself is concerned, I have enough information to render it justified.

As noted above, PC’s credibility in accounting for the rationality of belief perseverance can be undermined if there are alternative explanations of the phenomenon of lost justification. Here is one alternative explanation (Vahid 2004). Suppose we take the property of justification to be an objective property that beliefs possess when they are adequately grounded. It is also customary in the epistemology literature to distinguish between “being justified” or “having justification” and the “activity of justification” (Alston 1989). The idea is that just as one can be good, say, without being able to show that one possesses that virtue, one’s belief can have (and retain) the property of justification if it was initially based on adequate grounds, and there are currently no defeaters, without one being able to show that it is justified. With these distinctions in force, one could say that what the phenomenon of lost justification threatens is not the justification of one’s belief, but one’s ability to show that one is justified in holding that belief. The plausibility of this explanation depends, however, on the fate of some of the contentious issues in the internalism-externalism debate in epistemology.

5. Generation Conservatism

This section presents what is generally regarded as the standard version of conservatism, namely, GC. Given its mainstream status, GC has been more extensively discussed than the other versions of conservatism. Unlike the other two versions of conservatism, where what is at issue is the epistemic status of belief when one has lost track of its grounds or when one has been apprised of the evidentially equivalent competing hypotheses to that belief, generation conservatism (GC) is concerned with whether the very formation of a belief bears on its epistemic status. As Chisholm characterizes GC, the principle says that “anything we find ourselves believing may be said to have some presumption in its favor—provided it is not explicitly contradicted by the set of other things that we believe” (1980, pp. 551-552). Despite being the mainstream version of conservatism, GC also turns out to be its most controversial version.

There is no doubt that GC, if true, is a powerful epistemic tool for resolving a number of standing problems in epistemology, such as the problem of skepticism, the puzzle over the epistemic status of memory beliefs, and others. It has also been put to use to address a number of other challenges, like the problems facing internalism. For example, Smithies (2019) has argued for what he calls “phenomenal mentalism” according to which epistemic justification is determined only by our phenomenally individuated mental states, which include not only our conscious experiences but also our consciously accessible beliefs. More specifically, he defends a synchronic version of phenomenal mentalism, which takes epistemic justification to be determined by the phenomenal states you have now. This particular version of internalism is, however, vulnerable to the problem of forgotten evidence, as when a subject no longer remembers the ground of her justified belief (Goldman 1999). Along with other authors (McGrath 2007), Smithies thinks that GC provides a neat solution to this problem.

GC has also been the subject of many criticisms including, among other things, the “boost” and “conversion” objections as well as arbitrariness worries (for the latter, see below). The conversion problem says that when one has adequate evidence for two contrary hypotheses H₁ and H₂, one should withhold judgment. However, according to GC, by believing either of the hypotheses, the subject can convert her evidential situation from unjustified to justified, which is unacceptable. According to the boost problem, GC allows a subject to boost her justification for believing a proposition (p) by simply forming the belief. Suppose that S has evidence that supports p to some degree n. If GC is true, S can boost this support relation by simply believing that p. Following Feldman (2014), McCain (2020) has responded to this objection by rejecting the “additivity of evidence” principle, which says that if an agent S acquires new evidence that supports p while retaining any old evidence, then, in the absence of defeaters for p, S becomes better justified in believing p. The argument against this principle appeals to the possibility of redundant evidence; that is, evidence that makes no difference in levels of justification. Accordingly, there can be cases where S acquires new evidence for p without becoming better justified in believing p (Feldman 2014).

Another objection is that GC seems to conflict with the causal accounts of the basing relation (Frise 2017). The obtaining of the basing relation is what marks the transition from propositional to doxastic justification, and it is widely believed that causation must play a role in any viable account of the basing relation. The problem is that since a belief cannot cause itself at a time, the beliefs that GC claims are justified fail to satisfy the causal requirements for the basing relation (see McCain 2020 for a response). Finally, there is also the argument that GC lacks in intuitive plausibility. The idea is that it seems difficult to see how the bare fact of believing a proposition could confer justification on that belief. To get a sense of this unease, consider Christensen’s coin example again. I flip a coin which lands out of my sight and I form the belief that it has landed tails up without bothering to see if this is the case. GC seems to rule that this belief is justified, which is implausible. A response is that belief makes an epistemic contribution only when the subject lacks evidence for or against it (Poston 2012). If this is correct, though, it follows that a subject who believes that p in the absence of evidence for or against p would be placed in a position by GC to assert the following Moore-paradoxical sentence: <p but I have no evidence for p>. The awkwardness of allowing mere belief to be a source of justification does not disappear so easily (see Poston 2014, ch.2 for a response).

An important note, however, is that although constructing counterexamples to GC appears to be easy, it may be easier to beg the question against the proponent of GC. Consider, for example, an argument involving a possible scenario on the basis of which Foley (1982) rejects GC as being too strong. Consider subject S, who comes to believe a proposition H, which is not explicitly contradicted by anything else she believes, while, given her circumstances, it is more reasonable for S to believe not-H. By GC, S is justified in believing H. However, this scenario is under-described. For it is either the case that S has no evidence for H or not-H, in which case GC can be plausibly applied to S’s belief that H to ground her justification in believing that H, or it may be that, as Foley stipulates, S has better reasons for not-H than she has for H, in which case GC is no longer applicable because it takes the bare fact of believing a proposition to endow it with justification only in cases where there are no reasons against it. In such circumstances, it is not clear how, on pain of begging the question against the proponent of GC, one is to take believing not-H as being more reasonable than believing H.

In response to the above problems, the proponents of conservatism usually try to introduce certain modifications in their theses to make them more appealing. Although their official view is still the claim that it is the mere belief that confers justification on its content, closer observation reveals that these modified accounts often rely on such external factors as “seemings,” coherence, and evidence about our “general reliability” in order to enable their conservative theses to discharge their epistemic role. Before turning to such versions, though, it is important to consider some of the arguments that have been suggested for and against GC.

a. Arguing for and Against GC

i. The Transcendental Argument

A rather common transcendental argument for GC starts with the methodological question of how we are supposed to conduct our inquiries. One policy is to follow the Cartesian advice of dispensing with all our beliefs except those that are certain. This would seem to ensure that our beliefs satisfy the epistemic goal of believing truth and avoiding falsehood. Abandoning all our beliefs and trying to rebuild them from scratch, though, is close to cognitive suicide. The only way forward, then, is to work with what we have got and rely on our perspective in order to achieve the epistemic goal. Our perspective, however, consists not only of our mundane beliefs but also of our beliefs about which methods or belief-forming processes are reliable for regulating the formation of those mundane beliefs. There is no Archimedean point from which we can determine which of our belief-forming processes are reliable. Accordingly, there is no way to regulate our belief-forming activities except by relying on our antecedent convictions that constitute our perspective on the world. For those convictions to discharge this epistemic role, however, they must possess some epistemic worth to start with. Otherwise, our beliefs would fail to be justified. This means that mere belief, as GC claims, can confer some measure of justification on its content.

This argument can be resisted. Even if one may now appeal, a la GC, to the justified status of one’s background beliefs about the reliability of belief-forming processes in order to rationally and actively reaffirm a particular belief resulting from such processes, it is not clear that the belief in question was actually based on such background beliefs upon its inception (Podgorski 2016). So the justification now associated with the reaffirmation of the belief may not be the justification that was lost in the process. Another worry is that the motivations behind this argument might result in absurd consequences if the argument is repeatedly applied. Suppose, having formed a justified belief p by relying on my background beliefs, I take myself to have fulfilled the epistemic goal of truth and so consider the belief as justified. The type of conservatism that results from this argument would then seem to require that I hold on to the belief in the absence of a challenge from within my perspective. As Roger White argues, the same conservative motivations would also require me to avoid such challenges:

If I allow myself to critically rethink my commitment to p, there is a chance that I might   conclude that I was mistaken. But from my perspective now, to change my mind as to          whether p would be to be led into error. Of course I do not want that. So it is better for me to avoid all possible challenges and cling dogmatically to my current convictions. No one, I    take it, wants to endorse this sort of attitude. (2007, pp. 125-26)

Finally, there is the problem of arbitrariness that seems to arise from applying GC to our day-to-day cognitive dealings (White 2007 and Podgorski 2016). The idea is that it is possible for two or more subjects to have radically different perspectives, including different habits of thought that enjoy the same degree of coherence. According to GC, all such subjects are justified in their beliefs. Any insistence on the privileged status of one particular belief system over others invites the charge that the norms of epistemic impartiality are being violated. Moreover, if all belief systems are equally rational, it is not clear why one should not feel free to adopt the perspective of others.

ii. The Argument from Charity

Another argument (Vahid 2004) in defense of GC takes its inspirations from the consideration involving Davidson’s claim that belief ascription is constrained by the principle of charity. Very roughly, Davidson takes the evidence for the semantic theory to consist in the conditions under which speakers hold sentences true. The holding of a sentence true by a speaker is, however, a function of both what she means by that sentence as well as what she believes. This means that belief cannot be inferred without prior knowledge of the meaning, and meaning cannot be deduced without the belief. This is where Davidson appeals to the principle of charity. The idea is that we can solve the problem of the interdependence of belief and meaning “by holding the belief constant as far as possible while solving for meaning. This is accomplished by assigning truth conditions to alien sentences that make native speakers right when plausibly possible, according, of course, to our own view of what is right” (Davidson 1984, p.137). Thus understood, we may view the application of the principle of charity as involving the maximization of truth by the interpreter’s own lights.

Now, if belief ascription is to be constrained by charity and the latter is characterized by the aim of maximizing truth and minimizing falsity in the speaker’s belief system, then this would seem to endow the ascribed belief with some presumption of rationality, since justification (rationality) is also generally understood in terms of promoting the truth goal. A belief is justified in so far as it promotes the epistemic goal of believing what is true and not believing what is false. It should be noted, however, that since charity begins at home, the ascriber’s (interpreter’s) beliefs are as much subject to the constraint of charity as are the beliefs of the subject (interpretee) to whom beliefs are ascribed. One problem with this approach is that since charity requires the assignment of truth conditions to the interpretee’s sentences according to the interpreter’s view of what is right, the kind of rationality that emerges from this belief ascription process is one that is perspective-dependent and thus very weak. Although this seems to comport well with Chisholm’s own estimate of GC as constituting the “lowest” degree of epistemic justification (1980, 547), it will not be of much interest to those philosophers who think that conservatism is a substantial epistemic thesis.

The possible failure of the above arguments to fully substantiate the epistemic credentials of GC has not, however, deterred its proponents from coming up with modified versions of the thesis that no longer suffer from the problems that have afflicted the original version. Before considering these modified versions of GC, it pays to consider an argument against GC that denies that ordinary people are even capable of holding bare beliefs, and so concludes that, since the evaluation of GC requires the possibility of such beliefs, it is practically impossible to evaluate such a thesis.

Daniel Coren (2018) has claimed that the nature of bare belief makes it impossible to evaluate GC. He takes it that a bare belief is supposed to be a belief that is stripped of all personal memory and epistemic context. Although Coren regards such beliefs as logically conceivable, he thinks that for us, human agents, they are practically inconceivable. Even in the case of forgotten evidence, says Coren, it is not the case that one’s beliefs stand entirely on their own without any support from what the agent can recall. There are always some epistemic contexts within which our beliefs can be located. Coren realizes that there are some seemingly plausible examples where beliefs seem to lack such contexts as when, as a result of hypnosis or a bang on my head, I come to believe that, say, the number of stars in the universe is a prime number.

In response, he denies that such cases of belief-formation (involving hypnosis or brain injury) are practically possible. He says that he can imagine guessing or wanting the number of stars to be a prime number. However, being an ordinary agent, he cannot imagine being in such an extraordinary, non-human state of believing that the number of stars is prime while having no supporting reasons. To conclude, Coren’s main objection to conservatism is that since we are not “able to imagine having a belief in total isolation from other beliefs…[we cannot] evaluate the question of whether having a bare belief would have any positive epistemic status” (2018, p.10).

While Coren’s skeptical observations about the possibility of bare beliefs is a useful antidote to the often loose and fast way that conservatives play with such beliefs, it may not be advisable to base a critique of conservatism completely on empirical claims such as the practical impossibility of beliefs resulting from hypnosis or the formation of beliefs that are not sensitive to epistemic reasons. After all, there are views that countenance forming beliefs on the basis of pragmatic reasons (Leary 2017 and Rinard 2018). Moreover, not all processes resulting in belief need to be of a cognitive variety. Beliefs can come and go as a direct result of brain injury. Only beliefs that are the result of a cognitive process carry the distinction of being responsive to reasons.

More importantly, there are at least two ways of understanding Coren’s analysis of a bare belief in terms of a “belief in total isolation from other beliefs” depending on whether “isolation” is understood as conceptual or epistemic isolation. It is surely true that beliefs cannot be held in conceptual isolation. For, being conceptually structured, beliefs are said to be inferentially integrated with other beliefs such that their combination can yield further beliefs as consequences (Stich 1978). This is what lies behind Jerry Fodor’s (1983) denial that cognitive systems, unlike perceptual systems, are modular and informationally encapsulated. A conservative, though, need not challenge the preceding observations. What she claims is rather that beliefs can acquire their epistemic status in epistemic isolation from other beliefs. Although beliefs always appear in holistic networks with other beliefs, it is possible for some of them, says the conservative, to acquire their justification in epistemic isolation. At the risk of begging the question against such conservatives, the impossibility of having beliefs in total epistemic isolation from other beliefs cannot serve as a premise in an argument against conservatism.

b. Modifying GC

It was pointed out that the problems arising from the attempts to substantiate the standard formulation of GC have prompted some conservatives to suggest alternative formulations of the conservative principle that are no longer vulnerable to those difficulties. These versions of GC either involve appending further conditions to GC or seek to radically revise some of its assumptions.

i. Conservatism as the Principle of Credulity

An early attempt to modify GC by adding further restrictions to it is due to William Lycan (1988). Lycan presents his version of GC as the “principle of credulity” according to which the “seeming” plausibility (truth) of beliefs is sufficient for their acceptance. He takes this principle to underlie the justification of what he calls “spontaneous beliefs,” namely, beliefs that are directly produced by such sources as perception, memory, and so forth. Lycan’s’s choice of the beliefs that are rendered justified by his principal of credulity, namely perceptual and memory beliefs, raises, however, the suspicion that what we are dealing with here is in fact an instance of the thesis of phenomenal conservatism (discussed earlier), according to which if it seems to you that p, then, in the absence of defeaters, you are justified in believing that p. For the phenomenal conservative such seemings (perceptual, memorial, intuitive, and so forth) constitute the general source of justification for the beliefs to which they give rise, whereas for the upholders of GC it is the mere fact of believing of a proposition that endows that proposition with some epistemic worth.

Leaving this point to one side, Lycan’s recognition of the over-permissiveness of his principle in justifying what he regards as “wild” spontaneous beliefs, such as religious and superstitious beliefs, prompts him to add a number of restrictions on it, such as consistency with previously justified explanatory beliefs as well as the availability of an explanation by the agent’s belief system of how his or her spontaneous beliefs are produced. He requires that:

[Our] total body of beliefs and theories yield an idea of how… spontaneous belief[s] [were] produced in us. Finally suppose that according to this idea or explanation, the mechanism that produced the belief was (as we may say) a reliable one, in good working order. Then, I submit, our spontaneous beliefs are fully justified. (1988, p.168)

Although such constraints might exclude Lycan’s “wild” beliefs, they seem to be so stringent that it is unlikely that they can even be satisfied in the case of spontaneous perceptual and memory beliefs. With Lycan’s principal of credulity, we have, once more, an example of a seemingly conservative principal whose epistemic engine is driven not by the mere holding of a belief itself but by factors external to that belief.

ii. Conservatism as Believing in the Absence of Defeaters

Lycan’s principle of credulity is not the only way of evading the problems that are associated with GC. Kevin McCain (2008) suggests another way of getting around such problems that involves appending GC with two defeating conditions along the following lines:

PEC	If S believes that p and p is not incoherent, then S is justified in retaining the belief that p and S remains justified in believing that p so long as p is not defeated for S.
Defeating Condition (C1)	If S has better reasons for believing that not-p than S’s reason for believing that p, then S is no longer justified in believing that p.
Defeating Condition (C2)	If S’s reasons for believing p and not-p are equally good and the belief that not-p coheres equally as well or better than the belief that p does with S’s other beliefs, then S is no longer justified in believing that p.

McCain’s account of conservatism involves references to both the fact of believing something as well as the absence of defeaters. He is quite explicit, though, that while S’s belief that p provides S with justification, the belief itself “is not counted among S’s reasons” (2008, p.187). He claims that the role that that the belief plays in its justification is akin to the role that the absence of defeaters plays in the justification of a belief. Perhaps what McCain has in mind here is that believing that p is merely an enabler for the reason that is supposed to justify the belief. It is not, however, clear what, once the belief itself is excluded from the realm of reasons, is supposed to play that role when one appeals to the conservative thesis. Closer examination of McCain’s account reveals, however, that this role is played by such notions as evidence and coherence in the account’s defeating conditions. (C1) requires that evidence for not-p not be stronger than evidence for p, and (C2) requires an asymmetry in the coherence of p and not-p with the rest of the agent’s beliefs. Thus, far from relying on mere belief to confer justification on its content, it is the strength of evidence for the belief as well as the coherence of the target belief p with the rest of the subject’s belief repertoire that are doing the main epistemic work. This conclusion can receive further support when we turn to McCain’s claims, on behalf of his account, that it can resolve skeptical and other standing problems of epistemology.

To illustrate, consider some of the ambitious claims that McCain makes on behalf of PEC. He thinks, for example, that his version of conservatism is able to neutralize the challenge presented by Cartesian-style skeptical arguments that seek to undermine our beliefs in the external world by proposing alternative hypotheses, such as dreaming, being a brain in a vat, and so forth, that can also explain our evidence (perceptual experience). According to McCain, his conservative thesis explains why the skeptical argument fails, for none of the skeptical hypotheses provide a defeater that satisfy C1. Evidence in favor of these hypotheses is no better than evidence in favor of the belief about the external world. Neither is C2 satisfied because our belief in the external world coheres better with our overall set of beliefs, including our commonsense beliefs such as, “It is raining now,” “I slept last night,” and so forth.

The crucial premise in McCain’s argument is that “[a]lthough these commonsense beliefs are closely related to the belief that there is an external world, they are not directly dependent upon the belief that that there is an external world. We do not form the belief that there is an external world and then infer from them the belief that ‘the sun is shining today,’ etc.” (2008, pp. 189-190). It is true that this is not how we form our commonsense beliefs. However, McCain makes an important assumption when clarifying his defeating condition C2. C2 prohibits that not-p cohere equally as well or better than the belief that p does with S’s other beliefs. This prompts the question of what sort of beliefs should be included in that repertoire when one is assessing whether the belief that p is justified. On pain of guaranteeing that C2 would not be met, McCain thinks that, as a necessary condition, neither p nor “any belief q that is directly dependent upon the belief that p for its justification should…be included in S’s set of beliefs in regard to [C2]” (2008, p.187). As this remark clearly indicates, beliefs that are to be included in the agent’s belief system are supposed not to depend on the target belief p in an epistemic, rather than an inferential, sense. They are supposed not to be “directly dependent upon the belief that p for [their] justification.” In other words, McCain is assuming that commonsense beliefs can be justified independently of whether or not one is justified in believing that there is an external world, and this is where his conservatism is helping itself to an assumption from outside of conservatism’s sphere.

To explain, just as his version of conservatism owed its epistemic bite to the involvement of such notions as evidence and coherence, its purported broader epistemic uses in resolving long standing epistemic disputes equally derives its power not from the thesis itself but from some substantive epistemological theory, namely dogmatism (liberalism), in its background. According to dogmatism, absent defeaters, experience is sufficient, on its own, to confer justification on the belief in its content. This accounts for why McCain thinks that commonsense beliefs (in the subject’s belief set) can be justified without being dependent for their justification on belief about the external world. By contrast, a rival theory such as Crispin Wright’s conservatism maintains that experiences can only justify one’s commonsense beliefs provided one is already warranted in believing that there is an external world. It is clear then that what is really doing the epistemic work in McCain’s response to the skeptical argument is not his conservatism as such but the dogmatist account of perceptual justification that is presupposed in that account. With such a view in place, there would be no need to appeal to doxastic conservatism.

iii. Conservatism as a Dynamic Strategy

 Another approach, from Abelard Podgorski (2016), recommends a dynamic strategy in response to the problems discussed so far. Podgorski agrees with many of the objections that have been leveled against conservatism, such as bootstrapping and arbitrariness. Accordingly, he seeks to present an alternative conservative view that, while incorporating the basic motivations for GC, is not susceptible to its weaknesses. His proposal involves a dynamic interpretation of the rational relevance of two types of considerations: those that bear on the question of whether p and those that bear on the question of whether to make up one’s mind about p. He intends the dynamic slant to make it clear that the relevant norms governing our epistemic life are those that govern processes, rather than states, in particular the process of considering whether p, for some proposition p. Two such norms are distinguished: those that regulate when to initiate the process of considering whether p is true and those that govern the rational operation of that process.

Accordingly, what is distinctive of dynamic conservatism is that it appeals not to the norms that generate an agent’s mental states at particular times but to the norms that govern the process of considering whether p. To see how the dynamic approach intends to secure conservatism, Podgorski introduces the following norm for regulating the initiation of consideration.

Inconsiderate

One is not always rationally required to initiate consideration whether p when one believes that p and one’s evidence does not make p worth believing (from one’s perspective).

If Inconsiderate is true, one may permissibly fail to reconsider belief in p while one’s evidence does not make p worth believing. Now, just as there are things that bear on whether or not something is worth believing, there are things that bear on whether a question is worth opening for consideration. For example, it is worth considering whether p if it is important that my belief p is true, or my evidential situation regarding p is significantly better now than it was before or will be in the future. On the other hand, it is less worth considering whether p if, say, it does not matter whether my belief p is true, or if my evidential situation regarding p is worse than it was when I last considered p. Costs involving time and cognitive effort can also negatively bear on if it is worth considering whether p. Since Podgorski takes not considering to have a default permissible status, he concludes that “[w]e are not required to consider a question until we have some special positive reason to do so. So agents will be rational in maintaining any given belief for at least as long as they do not encounter such a reason” (2016, pp. 366-67).

Podgorski claims that, like standard conservatism, dynamic conservatism is also sensitive to the fact that changing beliefs incurs cognitive costs. It also explains the phenomenon of lost justification or evidence, for as long as an agent lacks reasons to reconsider her belief, she may, even having lost her evidence, persist in her belief. However, by rejecting the claim that bare belief can confer justification on its content, dynamic conservatism differs from the standard version. On the dynamic view, the belief that is held by an agent need not be worth having, because “by rejecting state-oriented norms demanding the worthiness of our beliefs, we allow that there are periods of time where what a belief has going for it simply does not matter for an agent’s rationality” (2016, p. 372).

However, it may be that by rejecting the main tenet of GC, dynamic conservatism becomes too modest to have an epistemic impact when it comes to regulating our belief-forming processes. Consider, for example, a case of forgotten evidence where, having forgotten the original evidence, there happens to be some reason to effectively reconsider our belief, since its truth turns out to be important in that context. Here, evidentialists usually appeal to second-order evidence (about, say, the general reliability of memory, and so forth). As we have seen, however, this sort of evidence is legitimate only if the belief in question was originally based on that evidence. Therefore, while this evidence can be used to ground the rationality of one’s active reaffirmation of that belief, it fails to explain one’s rationality when one does not perform such affirmation. Dynamic conservatism, however, seems to fall short in the opposite direction.

It can explain the rationality of the agent’s holding on to his belief in the cases of forgotten evidence, where he lacks a special reason to reconsider that belief. It also explains such cases without locating the source of this rationality in the agent’s current or past evidence. It seems to fall short of accounting for the agent’s rationality in the sort of cases described above, where there is reason to reconsider one’s belief. As Podgorski admits, “[t]he cases the [dynamic] view does not endorse as rational are those where an agent actively reaffirms their belief without relevant second-order information. And these are the cases where it is least intuitive that doxastic inertia is rational. Nevertheless, if these are taken to be core cases, it must be admitted that this is a genuine disadvantage of the dynamic approach” (2016, p. 370).

6. Conclusion

The doxastic conservatism debate develops out of the attempts to show that our tendency to maintain and preserve our beliefs beyond the evidence at our disposal is a rational phenomenon. Conservatism presents itself as a normative thesis with the potential to resolve a number of outstanding issues in epistemology. It turns out, however, that there is not just one single conservative principle, but a variety of such theses. Further discussions of doxastic conservatism may focus on these contenders and how they relate to the properties of belief relevant to the epistemic evaluation of doxastic states when one encounters evidentially equivalent alternatives, the perseverance of doxastic states in the absence of specific reasons to change them, and whether features of one’s doxastic state can add to the justification of the beliefs that constitute it.

7. References and Further Reading

• Adler, J. 1990. “Conservatism and Tacit Confirmation,” Mind 99: 559-570.
• Alston, W. 1989. Epistemic Justification, Cornell University Press.
• Chisholm, R. 1980. “A Version of Foundationalism” in Wettstein, et al (eds.), Midwest Studies in Philosophy V, University of Minnesota Press.
• Christensen, D. 1994. “Conservatism in Epistemology,” Nous 28: 69-89.
• Christensen, D. 2000. “Diachronic coherence and epistemic impartiality,” The Philosophical review 109, 3: 349-371.
• Coren, D. 2018. “Epistemic conservatism and bare beliefs,” Synthese https://doi.org/10.1007/s11229-018-02059-8.
• Davidson, D. 1984. “Radical Interpretation,” reprinted in Inquires into Truth and Interpretation, Oxford: Clarendon.
• Feldman, R. 2014. “Evidence of evidence is evidence” in Matheson, J. and R. Vitz (eds.), The Ethics of Belief, New York: Oxford University Press: 284–300.
• Fodor, J. 1983. The Modularity of Mind. MIT Press.
• Foley, R. 1982. “Epistemic Conservatism,” Philosophical Studies 43: 165-182.
• Foley, R. 1987. The Theory of Epistemic Rationality, Harvard University Press.
• Frise, M. 2017. “Internalism and the problem of stored beliefs,” Erkenntnis 82: 285–304.
• Fumerton, R. 2007. “Epistemic conservatism: Theft or honest toil?” Oxford Studies in Epistemology 2: 63–86.
• Goldman, A. 1979. “Varieties of Epistemic Appraisal,” Nous 13: 23-38.
• Goldman, A. 1986. Epistemology and Cognition, Harvard University Press.
• Goldman, A. 1999. “Internalism Exposed,” The Journal of Philosophy 96: 271-293.
• Goldstick, D. 1971. “Methodological Conservatism,” American Philosophical Quarterly 8: 186-191.
• Harman, G. 1986. Change in View, MIT Press.
• Huemer, Michael. 2001. Skepticism and the Veil of Perception, Rowman and Littlefield.
• Kvanvig, J. 1989. “Conservatism and its Virtues,” Synthese, 79:143–163.
• Lycan, W. 1988. Judgement and Justification, Cambridge University Press.
• McCain, K. 2008. “The Virtues of Epistemic Conservatism,” Synthese, 164:185–200.
• McCain, K. 2020. “Epistemic Conservatism and the Basing relation,” in Carter, A. and P. Bondy (eds.) Well-Founded Belief, Routledge.
• McGrath, M. 2007. “Memory and Epistemic Conservatism,” Synthese, 157: 1–24.
• Moffett, M. 2007. “Reasonable Disagreement and Rational Group Inquiry”, Episteme 4, 3: 352-367.
• Podgorski, A. 2016. “Dynamic Conservatism,” Ergo, 3: 349–376.
• Poston, T. 2012. “Is There an ‘I’ in Epistemology?” Dialectica 6, 4: 517-541.
• Poston, T. 2014. Reason and Explanation: A Defense of Explanatory Coherentism, Palgrave Macmillan.
• Pryor, J. 2000. “The Skeptic and the Dogmatist,” Nous, 34: 517-49.
• Sklar, L. 1975. “Methodological Conservatism,” Philosophical Review LXXIV: 186-191.
• Smithies, D. 2019. The Epistemic Role of Consciousness, Oxford University Press.
• Stich, Stephen. 1978. “Beliefs and Subdoxastic States,” Philosophy of Science 45: 499– 518.
• Quine, W.V.O. 1951, “Two Dogmas of Empiricism” in From a Logical Point of View, 2^nd ed. New York: Harper & Row.
• Vahid, H. 2004. “Varieties of Epistemic Conservatism,” Synthese 141: 97-122.
• Vogel, J. 1992. “Sklar on Methodological Conservatism,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 52: 125-131.
• White, R. 2007. “Epistemic Subjectivism,” Episteme 4: 115-129.
• Wright, C. 2004. “Warrant for Nothing (and Foundations for Free)?” Aristotelian Society Supplementary Volume, 78, 1:167–212.

 

Author Information

Hamid Vahid
Email: hamid36vahid@gmail.com
Institute for Research in Fundamental Sciences
Iran