Virtue Epistemology

Virtue epistemology is a collection of recent approaches to epistemology that give epistemic or intellectual virtue concepts an important and fundamental role. Virtue epistemologists can be divided into two groups, each accepting a different conception of what an intellectual virtue is.

Virtue reliabilists conceive of intellectual virtues as stable, reliable and truth-conducive cognitive faculties or powers and cite vision, introspection, memory, and the like as paradigm cases of intellectual virtue. These virtue epistemologists tend to focus on formulating virtue-based accounts of knowledge or justification. Virtue reliabilist accounts of knowledge and justification are versions of epistemological externalism. Consequently, whatever their strengths as versions of externalism, virtue reliabilist views are likely to prove unsatisfying to anyone with considerable internalist sympathies.

Virtue responsibilists conceive of intellectual virtues as good intellectual character traits, like attentiveness, fair-mindedness, open-mindedness, intellectual tenacity, and courage, traits that might be viewed as the traits of a responsible knower or inquirer. While some virtue responsibilists have also attempted to give virtue-based accounts of knowledge or justification, others have pursued less traditional projects, focusing on such issues as the nature and value of virtuous intellectual character as such, the relation between intellectual virtue and epistemic responsibility, and the relevance of intellectual virtue to the social and cross-temporal aspects of the intellectual life.

There is however a sense in which the very distinction between virtue reliabilism and virtue responsibilism is sketchier than it initially appears. Indeed, the most plausible version of virtue reliabilism will incorporate many of the character traits of interest to virtue responsibilists into its repertoire of virtues and in doing so will go significant lengths toward bridging the gap between virtue reliabilism and virtue responsibilism.

Table of Contents

1. Introduction to Virtue Epistemology
2. Virtue Reliabilism
   1. Key Figures
   2. Prospects for Virtue Reliabilism
3. Virtue Responsibilism
   1. Key Figures
   2. Prospects for Virtue Responsibilism
4. The Reliabilist/Responsibilist Divide
5. References and Further Reading

1. Introduction to Virtue Epistemology

Virtue epistemology is a collection of recent approaches to epistemology that give epistemic or intellectual virtue concepts an important and fundamental role.

The advent of virtue epistemology was at least partly inspired by a fairly recent renewal of interest in virtue concepts among moral philosophers (see, for example, Crisp and Slote 1997). Noting this influence from ethics, Ernest Sosa introduced the notion of an intellectual virtue into contemporary epistemological discussion in a 1980 paper, “The Raft and the Pyramid.” Sosa argued in this paper that an appeal to intellectual virtue could resolve the conflict between foundationalists and coherentists over the structure of epistemic justification. Since the publication of Sosa’s paper, several epistemologists have turned to intellectual virtue concepts to address a wide range of issues, from the Gettier problem to the internalism/externalism debate to skepticism.

There are substantial and complicated differences between the various virtue epistemological views; as a result, relatively little can be said by way of generalization about the central tenets of virtue epistemology. These differences are attributable mainly to two competing conceptions of the nature of an intellectual virtue. Sosa and certain other virtue epistemologists tend to define an intellectual virtue as roughly any stable and reliable or truth-conducive property of a person. They cite as paradigm instances of intellectual virtue certain cognitive faculties or powers like vision, memory, and introspection, since such faculties ordinarily are especially helpful for getting to the truth. Epistemologists with this conception of intellectual virtue have mainly been concerned with constructing virtue-based analyses of knowledge and/or justification. Several have argued, for instance, that knowledge should be understood roughly as true belief arising from an exercise of intellectual virtue. Because of their close resemblance to standard reliabilist epistemologies, these views are referred to as instances of “virtue reliabilism.”

A second group of virtue epistemologists conceives of intellectual virtues, not as cognitive faculties or abilities like memory and vision, but rather as good intellectual character traits, traits like inquisitiveness, fair-mindedness, open-mindedness, intellectual carefulness, thoroughness, and tenacity. These character-based versions of virtue epistemology are referred to as instances of “virtue responsibilism,” since the traits they regard as intellectual virtues might also be viewed as the traits of a responsible knower or inquirer. Some virtue responsibilists have adopted an approach similar to that of virtue reliabilists by giving virtue concepts a crucial role in an analysis of knowledge or justification. Linda Zagzebski, for instance, claims that knowledge is belief arising from what she calls “acts of intellectual virtue” (1996). Other virtue responsibilists like Lorraine Code (1987) have eschewed more traditional epistemological problems. Code argues that epistemology should be oriented on the notion of epistemic responsibility and that epistemic responsibility is the chief intellectual virtue; however, she makes no attempt to offer a definition of knowledge or justification based on these concepts. Her view instead gives priority to topics like the value of virtuous cognitive character as such, the social and moral dimensions of the intellectual life, and the role of agency in inquiry.

Virtue reliabilists and virtue responsibilists alike have claimed to have the more accurate view of intellectual virtue and hence of the general form that a virtue-based epistemology should take. And both have appealed to Aristotle, one of the first philosophers to employ the notion of an intellectual virtue, in support of their claims. Some virtue responsibilists (for example, Zagzebski 1996) have argued that the character traits of interest to them are the intellectual counterpart to what Aristotle and other moral philosophers have regarded as the moral virtues and that these traits are therefore properly regarded as intellectual virtues. In response, virtue reliabilists have pointed out that, whatever his conception of moral virtue, Aristotle apparently conceived of intellectual virtues more as truth-conducive cognitive powers or faculties than as good intellectual character traits. They have claimed furthermore that these powers, but not the responsibilist’s character traits, have an important role to play in an analysis of knowledge, and that consequently, the former are more reasonably regarded as intellectual virtues (Greco 2000).

It would be a mistake, however, to view either group of virtue epistemologists as necessarily having a weightier claim than the other to the concept of an intellectual virtue, for both are concerned with traits that are genuine and important intellectual excellences and therefore can reasonably be regarded as intellectual virtues. Virtue reliabilists are interested in cognitive qualities that are an effective means to epistemic values like truth and understanding. The traits of interest to virtue responsibilists are also a means to these values, since a person who is, say, reflective, fair-minded, perseverant, intellectually careful, and thorough ordinarily is more likely than one who lacks these qualities to believe what is true, to achieve an understanding of complex phenomena, and so forth. Moreover, these qualities are “personal excellences” in the sense that one is also a better person (albeit in a distinctively intellectual rather than straightforwardly moral way) as a result of possessing them, that is, as a result of being reflective, fair-minded, intellectually courageous, tenacious, and so forth. The latter is not true of cognitive faculties or abilities like vision or memory. These traits, while contributing importantly to one’s overall intellectual well-being, do not make their possessor a better person in any relevant sense. This is entirely consistent, however, with the more general point that virtue responsibilists and virtue reliabilists alike are concerned with genuine and important intellectual excellences both sets of which can reasonably be regarded as intellectual virtues. Virtue reliabilists are concerned with traits that are a critical means to intellectual well-being or “flourishing” and virtue responsibilists with traits that are both a means to and are partly constitutive of intellectual flourishing.

A firmer grasp of the field of virtue epistemology can be achieved by considering, for each branch of virtue epistemology, how some of its main proponents have conceived of the nature of an intellectual virtue and how they have employed virtue concepts in their theories. It will also be helpful to consider the apparent prospects of each kind of virtue epistemology.

2. Virtue Reliabilism

a. Key Figures

Since introducing the notion of an intellectual virtue to contemporary epistemology, Sosa has had more to say than any other virtue epistemologist about the intellectual virtues conceived as reliable cognitive faculties or abilities. Sosa characterizes an intellectual virtue, very generally, as “a quality bound to help maximize one’s surplus of truth over error” (1991: 225). Recognizing that any given quality is likely to be helpful for reaching the truth only with respect to a limited field of propositions and only when operating in a certain environment and under certain conditions, Sosa also offers the following more refined characterization: “One has an intellectual virtue or faculty relative to an environment E if and only if one has an inner nature I in virtue of which one would mostly attain the truth and avoid error in a certain field of propositions F, when in certain conditions C” (284). Sosa identifies reason, perception, introspection, and memory as among the qualities that most obviously satisfy these conditions.

Sosa’s initial appeal to intellectual virtue in “The Raft and the Pyramid” is aimed specifically at resolving the foundationalist/coherentist dispute over the structure of epistemic justification. (Sosa has since attempted to show that virtue concepts are useful for addressing other epistemological problems as well; the focus here, however, will be limited to his seminal discussion in the “The Raft and the Pyramid.”) According to Sosa, traditional formulations of both foundationalism and coherentism have fatal defects. The main problem with coherentism, he argues, is that it fails to give adequate epistemic weight to experience. The coherentist claims roughly that a belief is justified just in case it coheres with the rest of what one believes. But it is possible for a belief to satisfy this condition and yet be disconnected from or even to conflict with one’s experience. In such cases, the belief in question intuitively is unjustified, thereby indicating the inadequacy of the coherentist’s criterion for justification (1991: 184-85). Sosa also sees standard foundationalist accounts of justification as seriously flawed. The foundationalist holds that the justification of non-basic beliefs derives from that of basic or foundational beliefs and that the latter are justified on the basis of things like sensory experience, memory, and rational insight. According to Sosa, an adequate version of foundationalism must explain the apparent unity of the various foundationalist principles that connect the ultimate sources of justification with the beliefs they justify. But traditional versions of foundationalism, Sosa claims, seem utterly incapable of providing such an explanation, especially when the possibility of creatures with radically different perceptual or cognitive mechanisms than our own (and hence of radically different epistemic principles) is taken into account (187-89).

Sosa briefly sketches a model of epistemic justification that he says would provide the required kind of explanation. This model depicts justification as “stratified”: it attaches primary justification to intellectual virtues like sensory experience and memory and secondary justification to beliefs produced by these virtues. A belief is justified, according to the model, just in case it is has its source in an intellectual virtue (189). Sosa’s proposed view of justification is, in effect, an externalist version of foundationalism, since a belief can have its source in an intellectual virtue and hence be justified without this fact’s being internally or subjectively accessible to the person who holds it. This model provides an explanation of the unity of foundationalist epistemic principles by incorporating the foundationalist sources of epistemic justification under the concept of an intellectual virtue and offering a unified account of why beliefs grounded in intellectual virtue are justified (namely, because they are likely to be true). If Sosa’s criticisms of traditional coherentist and foundationalist views together with his own positive proposal are plausible, virtue reliabilism apparently has the resources to deal effectively with one of the more challenging and longstanding problems in contemporary epistemology.

John Greco also gives the intellectual virtues conceived as reliable cognitive faculties or abilities a central epistemological role. Greco characterizes intellectual virtues generally as “broad cognitive abilities or powers” that are helpful for reaching the truth. He claims, more specifically, that intellectual virtues are “innate faculties or acquired habits that enable a person to arrive at truth and avoid error in some relevant field.” These include things like “perception, reliable memory, and various kinds of good reasoning” (2002: 287).

Greco offers an account of knowledge according to which one knows a given proposition just in case one believes the truth regarding that proposition because one believes out of an intellectual virtue (311). This definition is broken down by Greco as follows. It requires, first, that one be subjectively justified in believing the relevant claim. According to Greco, one is subjectively justified in believing a given proposition just in case this belief is produced by dispositions that one manifests when one is motivated to believe what it is true. Greco stipulates that an exercise of intellectual virtue entails the manifestation of such dispositions. Second, Greco’s definition of knowledge requires that one’s belief be objectively justified. This means that one’s belief must be produced by one or more of one’s intellectual virtues. Third, Greco’s definition requires that one believe the truth regarding the claim in question because one believes the claim out of one or more of one’s intellectual virtues. In other words, one’s being objectively justified must be a necessary and salient part of the explanation for why one believes the truth.

Greco discusses several alleged virtues of his account of knowledge. One of these is the reply it offers to the skeptic. According to one variety of skepticism, we do not and cannot have any non-question-begging reasons for thinking that any of our beliefs about the external world are true, for any such reasons inevitably depend for their force on some of the very beliefs in question (305-06). Greco replies by claiming that the skeptic’s reasoning presupposes a mistaken view of the relation between knowledge and epistemic grounds or reasons. The skeptic assumes that to know a given claim, one must be in possession of grounds or reasons which, via some inductive, deductive, or other logical or quasi-logical principle, provide one with a cogent reason for thinking that the claim is true or likely to be true. If Greco’s account of knowledge is correct, this mischaracterizes the conditions for knowledge. Greco’s account requires merely that an agent’s grounds be reliable, or rather, that an agent herself be reliable on account of a disposition to believe on reliable grounds. It follows that as long as a disposition to form beliefs about the external world on the basis of sensory experience of that world is reliable, knowledge of the external world is possible for a person who possesses this disposition. But since an agent can be so disposed and yet lack grounds for her belief that satisfy the skeptic’s more stringent demands, Greco can conclude that knowledge does not require the satisfaction of these demands (307).

b. Prospects for Virtue Reliabilism

The foregoing indicates some of the ways that virtue reliabilist accounts of knowledge and justification may, if headed in the right general direction, provide helpful ways of addressing some of the more challenging problems in epistemology. It remains, however, that one is likely to find these views plausible only to the extent that one is already convinced of a certain, not wholly uncontroversial position that undergirds and partly motivates them.

Virtue reliabilist accounts of knowledge and justification are versions of epistemological externalism: they deny that the factors grounding one’s justification must be cognitively accessible from one’s first-person or internal perspective. Consequently, whatever their strengths as versions of externalism, virtue reliabilist views are likely to prove unsatisfying to anyone with considerable internalist sympathies. Consider, for example, a version of internalism according to which one is justified in believing a given claim just in case one has an adequate reason for thinking that the claim is true. It is not difficult to see why, if this account of justification were correct, the virtue reliabilist views considered above would be less promising than they might initially appear.

Sosa, for instance, attempts to resolve the conflict between foundationalism and coherentism by offering an externalist version of foundationalism. But traditionally, the coherentist/foundationalist debate has been an in-house debate among internalists. Coherentists and foundationalists alike have generally agreed that to be justified in believing a given claim is to have a good reason for thinking that the claim is true. The disagreement has been over the logical structure of such a reason, with coherentists claiming that the structure should be characterized in terms of doxastic coherence relations and foundationalists that it should be characterized mainly in terms of relations between foundational beliefs and the beliefs they support. Sosa rejects this shared assumption. He claims that justification consists in a belief’s having its source in an intellectual virtue. But a belief can have its source in an intellectual virtue without one’s being aware of it and hence without one’s having any reason at all for thinking that the belief is true. Therefore, Sosa’s response to the coherentism/foundationalism debate is likely to strike traditional coherentists and foundationalists as seriously problematic.

(It is worth noting in passing that in later work [for example, 1991], Sosa claims that the kind of justification just described is sufficient, when combined with the other elements of knowledge, merely for “animal knowledge” and not for “reflective” or “human knowledge.” The latter requires the possession of an “epistemic perspective” on any known proposition. While Sosa is not entirely clear on the matter, this apparently requires the satisfaction of something like either traditional coherentist or traditional foundationalist conditions for justification [see, for example, BonJour 1995].)

An internalist is likely to have a similar reaction to Greco’s response to the skeptic. Greco argues against skepticism about the external world by claiming that if a disposition to reason from the appearance of an external world to the existence of that world is in fact reliable then knowledge of the external world is possible for a person who possesses such a disposition. But this view allows for knowledge of the external world in certain cases where a person lacks any cogent or even merely non-question-begging reasons for thinking that the external world exists. As a result, Greco’s more lenient requirements for knowledge are likely to seem to internalists more like a capitulation to rather than a victory over skepticism.

Of course, these considerations do not by themselves show virtue reliabilism to be implausible, as the internalist viewpoint in question is itself a matter of some controversy. Indeed, Sosa and Greco alike have argued vigorously against internalism and have lobbied for externalism as the only way out of the skeptical bog. But the debate between internalists and externalists remains a live one and the foregoing indicates that the promise of virtue reliabilism hangs in a deep and important way on the outcome of this debate.

3. Virtue Responsibilism

a. Key Figures

Virtue responsibilism contrasts with virtue reliabilism in at least two important ways. First, virtue responsibilists think of intellectual virtues, not as cognitive faculties like introspection and memory, but rather as traits of character like attentiveness, intellectual courage, carefulness, and thoroughness. Second, while virtue reliabilists tend to focus on the task of providing a virtue-based account of knowledge or justification, several virtue responsibilists have seen fit to pursue different and fairly untraditional epistemological projects.

One of the first contemporary philosophers to discuss the epistemological role of the intellectual virtues conceived as character traits is Lorraine Code (1987). Code claims that epistemologists should pay considerably more attention to the personal, active, and social dimensions of the cognitive life and she attempts to motivate and outline an approach to epistemology that does just this. The central focus of her approach is the notion of epistemic responsibility, as an epistemically responsible person is especially likely to succeed in the areas of the cognitive life that Code says deserve priority. Epistemic responsibility, she claims, is the chief intellectual virtue and the virtue “from which other virtues radiate” (44). Some of these other virtues are open-mindedness, intellectual openness, honesty, and integrity. Since Code maintains that epistemic responsibility should be the focus of epistemology and thinks of epistemic responsibility in terms of virtuous intellectual character, she views the intellectual virtues as deserving an important and fundamental role in epistemology.

Code claims that intellectual virtue is fundamentally “a matter of orientation toward the world, toward one’s knowledge-seeking self, and toward other such selves as part of the world” (20). This orientation is partly constituted by what she calls “normative realism”: “[I]t is helpful to think of intellectual goodness as having a realist orientation. It is only those who, in their knowing, strive to do justice to the object – to the world they want to know as well as possible – who can aspire to intellectual virtue … Intellectually virtuous persons value knowing and understanding how things really are” (59). To be intellectually virtuous on Code’s view is thus to regard reality as genuinely intellectually penetrable; it is to regard ourselves and others as having the ability to know and understand the world as it really is. It is also to view such knowledge as an important good, as worth having and pursuing.

Code also claims that the structure of the intellectual virtues and their role in the intellectual life are such that an adequate conception of these things is unlikely to be achieved via the standard methodologies of contemporary epistemology. She claims that an accurate and illuminating account of the intellectual virtues and their cognitive significance must draw on the resources of fiction (201) and often must be content with accurate generalizations rather than airtight technical definitions (254).

Because of its uniqueness on points of both content and method, Code’s suggested approach to epistemology is relatively unconcerned with traditional epistemological problems. But she sees this as an advantage. She believes that the scope of traditional epistemology is too narrow and that it overemphasizes the importance of analyzing abstract doxastic properties (for example, knowledge and justification) (253-54). Her view focuses alternatively on cognitive character in its own right, the role of choice in intellectual flourishing, the relation between moral and epistemic normativity, and the social and communal dimensions of the intellectual life. The result, she claims, is a richer and more “human” approach to epistemology.

A second contemporary philosopher to give considerable attention to the intellectual virtues understood as character traits is James Montmarquet. Montmarquet’s interest in these traits arises from a prior concern with moral responsibility (1993). He thinks that to make sense of certain instances moral responsibility, an appeal must be made to a virtue-based conception of doxastic responsibility.

According to Montmarquet, the chief intellectual virtue is epistemic conscientiousness, which he characterizes as a desire to achieve the proper ends of the intellectual life, especially the desire for truth and the avoidance of error (21). Montmarquet’s “epistemic conscientiousness” bears a close resemblance to Code’s “epistemic responsibility.” But Montmarquet is quick to point out that a desire for truth is not sufficient for being fully intellectually virtuous and indeed is compatible with the possession of vices like intellectual dogmatism or fanaticism. He therefore supplements his account with three additional kinds of virtues that regulate this desire. The first are virtues of impartiality, which include “an openness to the ideas of others, the willingness to exchange ideas with and learn from them, the lack of jealousy and personal bias directed at their ideas, and the lively sense of one’s own fallibility” (23). A second set of virtues are those of intellectual sobriety: “These are the virtues of the sober-minded inquirer, as opposed to the ‘enthusiast’ who is disposed, out of sheer love of truth, discovery, and the excitement of new and unfamiliar ideas, to embrace what is not really warranted, even relative to the limits of his own evidence.” Finally, there are virtues of intellectual courage, which include “the willingness to conceive and examine alternatives to popularly held beliefs, perseverance in the face of opposition from others (until one is convinced that one is mistaken), and the determination required to see such a project through to completion” (23).

Montmarquet argues that the status of these traits as virtues cannot adequately be explained on account of their actual reliability or truth-conduciveness. He claims, first, that if we were to learn that, say, owing to the work of a Cartesian demon, the traits we presently regard as intellectual virtues actually lead us away from the truth and the traits we regard as intellectual vices lead us to the truth, we would not immediately revise our judgments about the worth or virtue of those epistemic agents we have known to possess the traits in question (for example, we would not then regard someone like Galileo as intellectually vicious) (20). Second, he points out that many of those we would regard as more or less equally intellectually virtuous (for example, Aristotle, Ptolemy, Galileo, Newton, and Einstein) were not equally successful at reaching the truth (21).

Montmarquet goes on to argue that the traits we presently regard as intellectual virtues merit this status because they are qualities that a truth-desiring person would want to have (30). The desire for truth therefore plays an important and basic normative role in Montmarquet’s account of intellectual virtue. The value or worth of this desire explains why the traits that emerge from it should be regarded as intellectual virtues.

Unlike Code, Montmarquet does not call for a reorientation of epistemology on the intellectual virtues. His concern is considerably narrower. He is interested mainly in cases in which an agent performs a morally wrong action which from her own point of view is morally justified. In some such cases, the person in question intuitively is morally responsible for her action. But this is possible, Montmarquet argues, only if we can hold the person responsible for the beliefs that permitted the action. He concludes that moral responsibility is sometimes grounded in doxastic responsibility.

Montmarquet appeals to the concept of an intellectual virtue when further clarifying the relevant sense of doxastic responsibility. He claims that in cases of the sort in question, a person can escape moral blame only if the beliefs that license her action are attributable to an exercise of intellectual virtue. Beliefs that satisfy this condition count as epistemically justified in a certain subjective sense (99). Thus, on Montmarquet’s view, the intellectual virtues are central to an account of doxastic responsibility which in turn is importantly related to the notion of moral responsibility.

Linda Zagzebski’s treatment of the intellectual virtues in her book Virtues of the Mind (1996) is one of the most thoroughly and systematically developed in the literature. Zagzebski is unquestionably a virtue responsibilist, as she clearly thinks of intellectual virtues as traits of character. That said, her view bears a notable resemblance to several virtue reliabilist views because its main component is a virtue-based account of knowledge.

Zagzebski begins this account with a detailed and systematic treatment of the structure of a virtue. She says that a virtue, whether moral or intellectual, is “a deep and enduring acquired excellence of a person” (137). She also claims that all virtues have two main components: a motivation component and a success component. Accordingly, to possess an intellectual virtue, a person must be motivated by and reliably successful at achieving certain intellectual ends. These ends are of two sorts (1999: 106). The first are ultimate or final intellectual ends like truth and understanding. Zagzebski’s account thus resembles both Code’s and Montmarquet’s, since she also views the intellectual virtues as arising fundamentally from a motivation or desire to achieve certain intellectual goods. The second set of ends consists of proximate or immediate ends that differ from virtue to virtue. The immediate end of intellectual courage, for instance, is to persist in a belief or inquiry in the face of pressure to give it up, while the immediate end of open-mindedness is to genuinely consider the merits of others’ views, even when they conflict with one’s own. Thus, on Zagzebski’s view, an intellectually courageous person, for instance, is motivated to persist in certain beliefs or inquiries out of a desire for truth and is reliably successful at doing so.

Zagzebski claims that knowledge is belief arising from “acts of intellectual virtue.” An “act of intellectual virtue” is an act that “gets everything right”: it involves having an intellectually virtuous motive, doing what an intellectually virtuous person would do in the situation, and reaching the truth as a result (1996: 270-71). One performs an act of fair-mindedness, for example, just in case one exhibits the motivational state characteristic of this virtue, does what a fair-minded person would do in the situation, and reaches the truth as a result. Knowledge is acquired when one forms a belief out of one or more acts of this sort.

As this characterization indicates, the justification or warrant condition on Zagzebski’s analysis of knowledge entails the truth condition, since part of what it is to perform an act of intellectual virtue is to reach the truth or to form a true belief, and to do so through certain virtuous motives and acts. This explains why Zagzebski characterizes knowledge simply as belief – rather than true belief – arising from acts of intellectual virtue.

Zagzebski claims that this tight connection between the warrant and truth conditions for knowledge makes her analysis immune to Gettier counterexamples (1996: 296-98). She characterizes Gettier cases as situations in which the connection between the warrant condition and truth condition for knowledge is severed by a stroke of bad luck and subsequently restored by a stroke of good luck. Suppose that during the middle of the day I look at the highly reliable clock in my office and find that it reads five minutes past 12. I form the belief that it is five past 12, and this belief is true. Unknown to me, however, the clock unexpectedly stopped exactly 12 hours prior, at 12:05 AM. My belief in this case is true, but only as a result of good luck. And this stroke of good luck cancels out an antecedent stroke of bad luck consisting in the fact that my ordinarily reliable clock has malfunctioned without my knowing it. While my belief is apparently both true and justified, it is not an instance of knowledge.

Zagzebski’s account of knowledge generates the intuitively correct conclusion in this and similar cases. My belief about the time, for instance, fails to satisfy her conditions for knowledge because what explains my reaching the truth is not any virtuous motive or activity on my part, but rather a stroke of good luck. Thus, by making it a necessary condition for knowledge that a person reach the truth through or because of virtuous motives and actions, Zagzebski apparently is able to rule out cases in which a person gets to the truth in the fortuitous manner characteristic of Gettier cases.

b. Prospects for Virtue Responsibilism

Virtue responsibilist views clearly are a diverse lot. This complicates any account of the apparent prospects of virtue responsibilism, since these prospects are likely to vary from one virtue responsibilist view to another. It does seem fairly clear, however, that as analyses of knowledge or justification, virtue responsibilism faces a formidable difficulty. Any such analysis presumably will make something like an exercise of intellectual virtue a necessary condition either for knowledge or for justification. The problem with such a requirement is that knowledge and justification often are acquired in a more or less passive way, that is, in a way that makes few if any demands on the character of the cognitive agent in question. Suppose, for example, that I am working in my study late at night and the electricity suddenly shuts off, causing all the lights in the room to go out. I will immediately know that the lighting in the room has changed. Yet in acquiring this knowledge, it is extremely unlikely that I exercise any virtuous intellectual character traits; rather, my belief is likely to be produced primarily, if not entirely, by the routine operation of my faculty of vision. Given this and related possibilities, an exercise of intellectual virtue cannot be a necessary condition for knowledge or justification.

This point has obvious implications for a view like Zagzebski’s. In the case just noted, I do not exhibit any virtuous intellectual motives. Moreover, while I may not act differently than an intellectually virtuous person would in the circumstances, neither can I be said to act in a way that is characteristic of intellectual virtue. Finally, I get to the truth in this case, not as a result of virtuous motives or actions, but rather as a result of the more or less automatic operation of one of my cognitive faculties. Thus, on several points, my belief fails to satisfy Zagzebski’s requirements for knowledge.

This suggests that any remaining hope for virtue responsibilism must lie with views that do not attempt to offer a virtue-based analysis of knowledge or justification. But such views, which include the views of Code and Montmarquet, also face a serious and rather general challenge. Virtue epistemologists claim that virtue concepts deserve an important and fundamental role in epistemology. But once it is acknowledged that these concepts should not play a central role in an analysis of knowledge or justification, it becomes difficult to see how the virtue responsibilist’s claim about the epistemological importance of the intellectual virtues can be defended, for it is at best unclear whether there are any other traditional epistemological issues or questions that a consideration of intellectual virtue is likely to shed much light on. It is unclear, for instance, how reflection on the intellectual virtues as understood by virtue responsibilists could shed any significant light on questions about the possible limits or sources of knowledge.

Any viable version of virtue responsibilism must, then, do two things. First, it must show that there is a unified set of substantive philosophical issues and questions to be pursued in connection with the intellectual virtues and their role in the intellectual life. In the absence of such issues and questions, the philosophical significance of the intellectual virtues and the overall plausibility of virtue responsibilism itself remain questionable. Second, if these issues and questions are to form the basis of an alternative approach to epistemology, they must be the proper subject matter of epistemology itself, rather than of ethics or some other related discipline.

The views of Code and Montmarquet appear to falter with respect to either one or the other of these two conditions. Code, for instance, provides a convincing case for the claim that the possession of virtuous intellectual character is crucial to intellectual flourishing, especially when the more personal and social dimensions of intellectual flourishing are taken into account. But she fails to identify anything like a unified set of substantive philosophical issues and questions that might be pursued in connection with these traits. Nor is it obvious from her discussion what such questions and issues might be. This leaves the impression that while Code has identified an important insight about the value of the intellectual virtues, this insight does not have significant theoretical implications and therefore cannot successfully motivate anything like an alternative approach to epistemology.

Montmarquet, on the other hand, does identify several interesting philosophical questions related to intellectual virtue, for example, questions about the connection between moral and doxastic responsibility, the role of intellectual character in the kind of doxastic responsibility relevant to moral responsibility, and doxastic voluntarism as it relates to issues of moral and doxastic responsibility. The problem with Montmarquet’s view as a version of virtue responsibilism, however, is that the questions he identifies seem like the proper subject matter of ethics rather than epistemology. While he does offer a virtue-based conception of epistemic justification, he is quick to point out that this conception is not of the sort that typically interests epistemologists, but rather is aimed at illuminating one aspect of moral responsibility (1993: 104). Indeed, taken as an account of epistemic justification in any of the usual senses, Montmarquet’s view is obviously problematic, since it is possible to be justified in any of these senses without satisfying Montmarquet’s conditions, that is, without exercising any virtuous intellectual character traits. (This again is due to the fact that knowledge and justification are sometimes acquired in a more or less passive way.) Montmarquet’s view therefore apparently fails to satisfy the second of the two conditions noted above.

Jonathan Kvanvig (1992) offers a treatment of the intellectual virtues and their role in the intellectual life that comes closer than that of either Code or Montmarquet to showing that there are substantive questions concerning these traits that might reasonably be pursued by an epistemologist. Kvanvig maintains that the intellectual virtues should be the focus of epistemological inquiry but that this is impossible given the Cartesian structure and orientation of traditional epistemology. He therefore commends a radically different epistemological perspective, one that places fundamental importance on the social and cross-temporal dimensions of the cognitive life and gives a backseat to questions about the nature and limits of knowledge and justification.

While the majority of Kvanvig’s discussion is devoted to showing that the traditional framework of epistemology leaves little room for considerations of intellectual virtue (and hence that this framework should be abandoned), he does go some way toward sketching a theoretical program motivated by his proposed alternative perspective that allegedly would give the intellectual virtues a central role. One of the main themes of this program concerns how, over the course of a life, “one progresses down the path toward cognitive ideality.” Understanding this progression, Kvanvig claims, would require addressing issues related to “social patterns of mimicry and imitation,” cognitive exemplars, and “the importance of training and practice in learning how to search for the truth” (172). Another crucial issue on Kvanvig’s view concerns “accounting for the superiority from an epistemological point of view of certain communities and the bodies of knowledge they generate.” This might involve asking, for instance, “what makes physics better off than, say, astrology; or what makes scientific books, articles, addresses, or lectures somehow more respectable from an epistemological point of view than books, articles, addresses or lectures regarding astrology” (176). Kvanvig maintains that answers to these and related questions will give a crucial role to the intellectual virtues, as he, like Code, thinks that the success of a cognitive agent in the more social and diachronic dimensions of the cognitive life depends crucially on the extent to which the agent embodies these virtues (183).

Kvanvig’s discussion along these lines is suggestive and may indeed point in the direction of a plausible and innovative version of virtue responsibilism. But without seeing the issues and questions he touches on developed and addressed in considerably more detail, it is difficult to tell whether they really could support a genuine alternative approach to epistemology and whether the intellectual virtues would really be the main focus of such an approach. It follows that the viability of virtue responsibilism remains at least to some extent an open question. But if virtue responsibilism is viable, this apparently must be on account of approaches that are in the same general vein as Kvanvig’s, that is, approaches that attempt to stake out an area of inquiry regarding the nature and cognitive significance of the intellectual virtues that is at once philosophically substantial as well as the proper subject matter of epistemology.

4. The Reliabilist/Responsibilist Divide

Virtue reliabilists and virtue responsibilists appear to be advocating two fundamentally different and perhaps opposing kinds of epistemology. The former view certain cognitive faculties or powers as central to epistemology and the latter certain traits of intellectual character. The two approaches also sometimes differ about the proper aims or goals of epistemology: virtue reliabilists tend to uphold the importance of traditional epistemological projects like the analysis of knowledge, while some virtue responsibilists give priority to new and different epistemological concerns. The impression of a deep difference between virtue reliabilism and virtue responsibilism is reinforced by at least two additional considerations. First, by defining the notion of intellectual virtue in terms of intellectual character, virtue responsibilists seem to rule out ex hypothesi any significant role in their theories for the cognitive abilities that interest the virtue reliabilist. Second, some supporters of virtue reliabilism have claimed outright that the character traits of interest to the virtue responsibilist have little bearing on the questions that are most central to a virtue reliabilist epistemology (Goldman 1992: 162).

But the divide between virtue reliabilism and virtue responsibilism is not entirely what it seems. Minimally, the two approaches are not always incompatible. A virtue reliabilist, for instance, can hold that relative to questions concerning the nature of knowledge and justification, a faculty-based approach is most promising, while still maintaining that there are interesting and substantive epistemological questions (even if not of the traditional variety) to be pursued in connection with the character traits that interest the virtue responsibilist (see, for example, Greco 2002).

More importantly, there is a sense in which the very distinction between virtue reliabilism and virtue responsibilism is considerably sketchier than it initially appears. Virtue reliabilists conceive of intellectual virtues, broadly, as stable and reliable cognitive qualities. In developing their views, they go on to focus more or less exclusively on cognitive faculties or powers like introspection, vision, reason, and the like. To a certain extent, this approach is quite reasonable. After all, the virtue reliabilist is fundamentally concerned with those traits that explain one’s ability to get to the truth in a reliable way, and in many cases, all that is required for reaching the truth is the proper functioning of one’s cognitive faculties. For example, to reach the truth about the appearance of one’s immediate surroundings, one need only have good vision. Or to reach the truth about whether one is in pain, one need only be able to introspect. Therefore, as long as virtue reliabilists limit their attention to instances of knowledge like these, a more or less exclusive focus on cognitive faculties and related abilities seems warranted.

But reaching the truth often requires much more than the proper operation of one’s cognitive faculties. Indeed, reaching the truth about things that matter most to human beings—for example, matters of history, science, philosophy, religion, and morality—would seem frequently to depend more, or at least more saliently, on rather different qualities, many of which are excellences of intellectual character. An important scientific discovery, for example, is rarely explainable primarily in terms of a scientist’s good memory, excellent eyesight, or proficiency at drawing valid logical inferences. While these things may play a role in such an explanation, this role is likely to be secondary to the role played by other qualities, for instance, the scientist’s creativity, ingenuity, intellectual adaptability, thoroughness, persistence, courage, and so forth. And many of these are the very traits of interest to the virtue responsibilist.

It appears that since virtue reliabilists are principally interested in those traits that play a critical or salient role in helping a person reach the truth, they cannot reasonably neglect matters of intellectual character. They too should be concerned with better understanding the nature and intellectual significance of the character traits that interest the virtue responsibilist. Indeed, the most plausible version of virtue reliabilism will incorporate many of these traits into its repertoire of virtues and in doing so will go significant lengths toward bridging the gap between virtue reliabilism and virtue responsibilism.

5. References and Further Reading

• Aristotle. 1985. Nicomachean Ethics, trans. Terence Irwin (Indianapolis: Hackett).
• Axtell, Guy. 1997. “Recent Work in Virtue Epistemology,” American Philosophical Quarterly 34: 1-27.
• Axtell, Guy, ed. 2000. Knowledge, Belief, and Character (Lanham, MD: Rowman & Littlefield).
• BonJour, Laurence. 1995. “Sosa on Knowledge, Justification, and ‘Aptness’,” Philosophical Studies 78: 207-220. Reprinted in Axtell (2000).
• Code, Lorraine. 1987. Epistemic Responsibility (Hanover, NH: University Press of New England).
• Crisp, Roger and Michael Slote, eds. 1997. Virtue Ethics (Oxford: Oxford UP).
• DePaul, Michael and Linda Zagzebski. 2003. Intellectual Virtue: Perspectives from Ethics and Epistemology (Oxford: Oxford UP).
• Fairweather, Abrol and Linda Zagzebski. 2001. Virtue Epistemology: Essays on Epistemic Virtue and Responsibility (New York: Oxford UP).
• Goldman, Alvin. 1992. “Epistemic Folkways and Scientific Epistemology,” Liaisons: Philosophy Meets the Cognitive and Social Sciences (Cambridge, MA: MIT Press).
• Greco, John. 1992. “Virtue Epistemology,” A Companion to Epistemology, eds. Jonathan Dancy and Ernest Sosa (Oxford: Blackwell).
• Greco, John. 1993. “Virtues and Vices of Virtue Epistemology,” Canadian Journal of Philosophy 23: 413-32.
• Greco, John. 1999. “Agent Reliabilism,” Philosophical Perspectives 13, Epistemology, ed. James Tomberlin (Atascadero, CA: Ridgeview).
• Greco, John. 2000. “Two Kinds of Intellectual Virtue,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 60: 179-84.
• Greco, John. 2002. “Virtues in Epistemology,” Oxford Handbook of Epistemology, ed. Paul Moser (New York: Oxford UP).
• Hookway, Christopher. 1994. “Cognitive Virtues and Epistemic Evaluations,” International Journal of Philosophical Studies 2: 211-27.
• Kvanvig, Jonathan. 1992. The Intellectual Virtues and the Life of the Mind (Savage, MD: Rowman & Littlefield).
• Montmarquet, James. 1992. “Epistemic Virtue,” A Companion to Epistemology, eds. Jonathan Dancy and Ernest Sosa (Oxford: Blackwell).
• Montmarquet, James. 1993. Epistemic Virtue and Doxastic Responsibility (Lanham, MD: Rowman & Littlefield).
• Plantinga, Alvin. 1993. Warrant and Proper Function (New York: Oxford UP).
• Sosa, Ernest. 1980. “The Raft and the Pyramid: Coherence versus Foundations in the Theory of Knowledge,” Midwest Studies in Philosophy V: 3-25. Reprinted in Sosa (1991).
• Sosa, Ernest. 1991. Knowledge in Perspective (Cambridge: Cambridge UP).
• Steup, Matthias. 2001. Knowledge, Truth, and Duty (Oxford: Oxford UP).
• Zagzebski, Linda. 1996. Virtues of the Mind (Cambridge: Cambridge UP).
• Zagzebski, Linda. 1998. “Virtue Epistemology,” Encyclopedia of Philosophy, ed. Edward Craig (London: Routledge).
• Zagzebski, Linda. 1999. “What Is Knowledge?” The Blackwell Guide to Epistemology, eds. John Greco and Ernest Sosa (Oxford: Blackwell).
• Zagzebski, Linda. 2000. “From Reliabilism to Virtue Epistemology,” Axtell (2000).

Author Information

Jason S. Baehr
Email: Jbaehr@lmu.edu
Loyola Marymount University
U. S. A.

Certainty

The following article provides an overview of the philosophical debate surrounding certainty. It does so in light of distinctions that can be drawn between objective, psychological, and epistemic certainty. Certainty consists of a valuable cognitive standing, which is often seen as an ideal. It is indeed natural to evaluate lesser cognitive standings, in particular beliefs and opinions, in light of one’s intuitions regarding what is certain. Providing an account of what certainty is has however proven extremely difficult; in one part because certainty comes in varieties that may easily be conflated, and in another part because of looming skeptical challenges.

Is certainty possible in the domain of the contingent? Or is it restricted, as Plato and Aristotle thought, to the realm of essential truths? The answer to this question depends heavily on whether or not a distinction can be drawn between the notion of objective certainty and the notion of epistemic certainty. How are we to characterize the epistemic position of a subject for whom a particular proposition is certain? Intuitively, if a proposition is epistemically certain for a subject, that subject is entitled to be psychologically certain of that proposition. Yet, as outlined by philosophers such as Unger, depending on how psychological certainty is conceived of, skeptical implications are looming. Depending on how psychological certainty is conceived of, it is not clear that a subject can be entitled in being psychological certain of a proposition. Generally, it has proven challenging to articulate a notion of epistemic certainty that preserves core intuitions regarding what one is entitled to think and regarding what characterizes, psychologically, the attitude of certainty.

Table of Contents

1. Varieties of Certainty
   1. Objective, Epistemic and Psychological Certainty
   2. Certainty and Knowledge
2. Psychological Certainty
   1. Certainty and Belief
   2. A Feeling of Conviction
   3. The Operational Model
3. Epistemic Certainty
   1. The Problem of Epistemic Certainty
   2. Skeptical Theories of Epistemic Certainty
      1. Radical Infallibilism
      2. Invariantist Maximalism
      3. Classical Infallibilism
      4. A Worry for Skeptical Theories of Certainty
   3. Moderate Theories of Epistemic Certainty
      1. Moderate Infallibilism
      2. Fallibilism
      3. Epistemic Immunity and Incorrigibility
   4. Weak Theories of Epistemic Certainty
      1. The Relativity of Certainty
      2. Contextualism
      3. Pragmatic Encroachment
4. Connections to Other Topics in Epistemology
5. References and Further Readings

1. Varieties of Certainty

a. Objective, Epistemic and Psychological Certainty

As a property, certainty can be attributed to a proposition or a subject. When attributed to a proposition, certainty can be understood metaphysically (objectively) or relative to a subject’s epistemic position (Moore 1959, DeRose 1998). Objective certainties consist of propositions that are necessarily true. The relevant types of necessities are logical, metaphysical and physical. For instance, the proposition “It rains in Paris”, even if true, cannot be regarded as objectively certain. This is because it is possible that it does not rain in Paris. On the other hand, the proposition “All bachelors are unmarried” can be regarded as objectively certain, for it is logically impossible that this proposition be false.

Epistemic certainties are propositions that are certain relative to the epistemic position of a subject and the notion of epistemic certainty ought to be distinguished from that of psychological certainty, which denotes a property attributed to a subject relative to a given proposition (Moore 1959, Unger 1975: 62sq, Klein 1981: 177sq, 1998, Audi 2003: 224 sq, Stanley 2008, DeRose 2009, Littlejohn 2011, Reed 2008, Petersen 2019, Beddor 2020a, 2020b, Vollet 2020). Consider the statement “It is certain for Peter that John is not sick”. Note that this statement is ambiguous, as, “for Peter” could refer to Peter’s epistemic position, for example, the evidence Peter possesses. If Peter states “It is certain that John is not sick, because the doctor told me so”, he can be understood as stating that “John is not sick” is certain given his epistemic position which comprises what the doctor told him. But “for Peter” can also denote an attitude adopted by Peter toward the proposition “John is not sick”. The attitude at issue is the type of attitude that falls under the concept of psychological certainty.

Epistemic certainty or epistemic uncertainty are often expressed by the use of modals such as “may” or “impossible” which are understood in an epistemic sense (see Moore 1959, DeRose 1998: 69, Littlejohn 2011, Petersen 2019, Beddor 2020b: sect. 5). To express epistemic certainty one can say, for instance, “It is impossible that John is sick, because the doctor said he wasn’t”. Likewise, to express epistemic uncertainty, one can say “John may be sick, as his temperature is high”. Used in such a way, these modals describe the epistemic position of a subject relative to a proposition toward which she may or may not adopt an attitude of certainty.

Even if it is intuitively correct that the epistemic position of a subject for whom some proposition is certain consists of a favorable epistemic position, it is an open question if a proposition being epistemically certain for a subject entails that that proposition is true. Depending on how the epistemic position relative to which a proposition that is epistemically certain for a subject is conceived of, epistemic certainty may not turn out to be factive (DeRose 1998 Hawthorne 2004: 28, Huemer 2007, von Fintel et Gillies 2007, Littlejohn 2011, Petersen 2019, Beddor 2020b, Vollet 2020).

Psychological certainty, for its part, is generally regarded as a being non-factive. For example, John can be psychologically certain that it is raining in Paris even if it is not raining in Paris. In addition, psychological certainty does not require that a subject be in a favorable epistemic position. It is possible for John to have no reason to believe that it is raining in Paris, and yet, be psychologically certain that it is raining in Paris.

Despite being conceptually distinct, the notions of objective, epistemic and psychological certainty are significantly related. From Antiquity to the end of the Middle Ages, the idea that true science (epistémè) – that is, epistemic certainty – could only pertain to necessary truths  whose object was either intelligible forms or essences seemed to be widely accepted. In The Republic books V, VI and VII, Plato endorses the view that sensible reality is merely an imperfect and mutable copy of an ideal, perfect and immutable realm of existence. As a result, sensible reality can only be the object of uncertain opinions (doxa). For his part, Aristotle defines epistemic certainty, or “scientific knowledge,” as the syllogistic demonstration of essential truths. It is through such syllogisms that one can comprehend what belongs essentially to objects of knowledge (Aristotle Organon IV. Posterior Analytics, I, 2, Metaphysics VII.2, 1027a20). It is during the Scientific Revolution that emerges the idea of a science of the contingent and of the possibility of distinguishing epistemic certainty from objective certainty.

In addition, epistemic certainty has an important normative relationship to psychological certainty (Klein 1998). For instance, Descartes states that one should not adopt an attitude of certainty toward propositions that are not entirely certain and indubitable (Descartes Meditations on First Philosophy § 2). Similarly, Locke’s evidentialist principle prescribes that a subject should proportionate her opinion to the evidence she possesses (Locke Essay, IV, 15 §5). Indeed, it seems that if a proposition is not epistemically certain for a subject, that subject is not justified in being certain that that proposition is true (Ayer 1956: 40, Unger 1975).

b. Certainty and Knowledge

According to several philosophers, the notions of psychological and epistemic certainty are closely connected to the notion of knowledge. One could regard the propositional attitude involved in knowing something to be the case as consisting of the attitude of psychological certainty and therefore take epistemic certainty to be a condition on knowledge. (Ayer 1956, Moore 1959, Unger 1975, Klein 1981). Such a view would explain why concessive knowledge attributions such as, “I know that I have hands, but I might be a handless brain in a vat” appear to be inconsistent (Lewis 1996).

However, there are reasons to draw a more substantial distinction between certainty and knowledge. First, as epistemic certainty is intuitively very demanding, taking it as a condition on knowledge could easily lead to the conclusion that ordinary knowledge is beyond one’s reach (Unger 1975). Second, there seem to be cases where some knowledge is attributed to a particular subject without that subject being described as psychologically certain (Stanley 2008, McGlynn 2014, Petersen 2019, Beddor 2020b, Vollet 2020). For instance, consider the statements, “I know that p for certain” or, “I know that p with certainty”. These statements are not redundant, and express something stronger than “I know that p” (Malcolm 1952, Beddor 2020b, Vollet 2020, Descartes distinguishes, for his part, cognitio and scientia: see Pasnau 2013).

In addition, concessive knowledge attributions can be explained by other means. According to some philosophers, a pragmatic implicature in tension with the attribution of knowledge is communicated whenever an epistemic possibility is explicitly considered during  a conversation. For instance, that this possibility is relevant when it comes to determining whether the subject knows that p (Rysiew 2001, Fantl and MacGrath 2009, Dougherty and Rysiew 2009, 2011, for difficulties raised by this type of explanation see Dodd 2010). Other philosophers explain the apparent inconsistency of concessive knowledge attributions by claiming that epistemic certainty is the norm of assertion (Stanley 2008, Pertersen 2019, Beddor 2020b, Vollet 2020).

Whether or not knowledge can be conceived of in terms certainty, because of the close connection between these notions and the centrality of questions pertaining to knowledge in epistemology, the philosophical discussion has been primarily focused on the notions of psychological and epistemic certainty. Therefore, the primary aim of this entry is to present the different ways in which these notions have been understood by philosophers. Note that the question of the relationship between epistemic and objective certainty will nevertheless be addressed in relation to infaillibilist conceptions of epistemic certainty.

2. Psychological Certainty

a. Certainty and Belief

There is an intuitive connection between psychological certainty and belief. Whenever a subject is certain of p, she takes p to be true which is characteristic of the attitude of belief. Yet, one can believe that p without being certain of p. One can reasonably state, “I believe that it will rain tomorrow, but I am not certain that it will” (Hawthorne, Rothschild and Spectre 2016, Rothshild 2020). Thus, being certain of p does not (merely) amount to believing that p (for versions of the claim that believing that p involves being certain that p, see Finetti 1990, Roorda 1995, Wedgwood 2012, Clarke 2013, Greco 2015, Dodd 2017 and Kauss 2020).

One way to conceive of the relationship between psychological certainty and belief is to introduce a “graded” notion of belief. Traditionally, philosophical discussion has relied on a binary notion of belief: either a subject believes a proposition, or she does not. But a subject can also be said to have a certain degree of belief in a proposition and given a graded notion of belief, psychological certainty can plausibly be conceived as the maximum degree of belief one could have in a proposition. For its part, the attitude of belief or outright belief is conceivable as a high, yet non-maximal degree of belief in a proposition (Foley 1992, Ganson 2008, Weatherson 2005, Sturgeon 2008: 154–160 and Leitgeb 2013, 2014, 2017).

Such a conception of psychological certainty raises, however, three important questions. First, what does it mean for a subject to have a particular degree of belief in a proposition? Second, how should degrees of belief be quantified? Third, what does it take for a subject to have the maximum degree of belief in a proposition?

b. A Feeling of Conviction

A first possibility is to consider that a subject’s degree of belief in p consists of an internally discernable feeling of conviction toward p’s truth (for a discussion of certainty as a metacognitive or epistemic feeling, see Dokic 2012, 2014; Vazard 2019; Vollet 2022). For example, consider the propositions “2+2=4” and “It will rain tomorrow.” Presumably, there is a discernable difference in one’s feeling of conviction toward the truth of each proposition. One’s conviction toward the truth of “2+2=4” is stronger than one’s conviction toward “It will rain tomorrow” and, given the view under examination, one’s degree of belief in “2+2=4” is thereby higher than one’s degree of belief in “it will rain tomorrow”. This is the case even if one believes that both “2+2=4” and “It will rain tomorrow” are true. Such a conception seems to prevail among philosophers such as Descartes and If a subject’s degree of belief in p consists of a certain feeling of conviction toward p’s truth, then psychological certainty is naturally conceived of a maximally strong feeling of conviction toward the truth of a proposition (see also Locke Essay, and Hume Enquiry).

Such a conception of psychological certainty is problemmatic however. First, many propositions which a particular subject is certain of at a given time may not be associated with a discernable feeling of conviction. One might be absolutely certain that 2+2=4 at t without having any particular feeling toward that proposition, for example, if one is not entertaining the thought that 2+2=4 at t. Second, it is not clear that the type of feeling that is supposed to illuminate the notion of psychological certainty has the required structure. In particular, it is not clear that such a feeling has upper and lower bounds. In light of these complications, it might be preferable, in order to explicate the notion of psychological certainty, to exploit the intuitive connection there is between that notion and the notion of doubt.

It is intuitively correct that if a subject is absolutely convinced that a proposition is true, her attitude toward that proposition leaves no room for doubt. The proposition, for that subject, is indubitable. For instance, one may have that degree of conviction toward the proposition, “I think, therefore I am ” because one finds it difficult—perhaps even impossible—to doubt it (see Ayer 1956: 44-45 for discussion). Note, however, that this characterization of psychological certainty remains ambiguous. It can be understood either synchronically or diachronically (Reed 2008); assuming that one distinguishes the degree of belief a subject can have in a proposition from the stability of this degree of belief (see Levi 1983: 165; Gärdenfors et Makinson 1988: 87, Skyrms 1980: 11f., Leitgeb 2013: 1348, 1359, Moon 2017 and Kauss 2020). From a synchronic perspective, it follows from this characterization that if a subject is certain that p at t, that subject has absolutely no doubt regarding p’s truth at t. However, it does not follow that the subject who is certain that p at t could not doubt that p at a later time t’. In contrast, from a diachronic perspective, it follows from this characterization of psychological certainty that if a subject is certain that p at t, then p is indubitable in the sense that any doubt concerning p’s truth is excluded for that subject, both at t, and at a later time t’.

Understood diachronically, this characterization of psychological certainty under examination is thus stronger and possibly better suited to explicate this type of attitude.  As a matter of fact, according to the synchronic reading, a belief very easily revisable could qualify as a psychological certainty. Yet, it seems that psychological certainty consists of something stronger than this. If a subject is absolutely convinced that p is true, one expects her attitude toward p to be stable.

Several ways of understanding what it takes for a proposition to be indubitable for a subject have been put forward. According to Peirce, the notion of doubt is not related to the mere contemplation of the possibility of a proposition being false (Peirce 1877 and 2011). Instead, doubt is characterized as a “mental irritation” resulting from the acquisition of unforeseen information which provides motivation to investigate a proposition’s truth further. According to this pragmatic conception of doubt, the exclusion of doubt regarding p’s truth is the result of a rational inquiry into the question of p’s truth and does not simply consist of a psychological impossibility to contemplate the possibility of p being false (Vazard 2019) .

In contrast, Malcolm and Unger adopt a Cartesian conception of doubt (Malcolm 1963 67-68, Unger 1975  30-31, 105 sq). For them, doubt regarding p’s truth is excluded for a subject at a time t whenever her attitude toward p at t is such that no information or experiences will lead her to change her mind regarding p. When a subject is certain that p and doubt regarding p’s truth is excluded for her, her attitude toward p is such that, for her, any consideration in favor of the conclusion that p is false is misleading. This means, for instance, that if a subject is certain that there is an ink bottle in front of her at t, her attitude toward the proposition “There is an ink bottle in front of me” is such that, at t, if she felt or had a visual experience as of her hand passing through that ink-bottle, this would not provide reason for her to think that there is not an ink bottle in front of her. Rather, it would provide reason for the subject to think that such sensory experiences are illusory.

For other philosophers, if a subject is certain that p, no data or experience could lead her to doubt that p is true without putting the totality of her beliefs into question, including beliefs concerning the data or experience prompting her to doubt that p is true in the first place (Miller 1978). That is, if a subject is certain that p, then any reason to doubt that p is true would constitute, for her, a reason to doubt absolutely anything, including the very existence of that reason.

This characterization of psychological certainty manages to capture the idea that this attitude differs from the attitude of belief in that it is not revisable. Note, however, that this characterization does not entail that no psychological event could alter one’s attitude of certainty. Even if any doubt regarding p’s truth is excluded for a subject at t, circumstances could lead her to doubt p’s truth. In addition, this characterization does not exclude the possibility of the subject acquiring, at a later time t’, evidence supporting the conclusion that p is false, and of losing, as a result, her conviction regarding p’s truth.

Additionally, the exclusion of doubt regarding p’s truth is not only related to the attitude adopted by a subject who is certain of p toward what counts as a reason to think that p is false. As noted by Unger, a subject’s absolute conviction that p is true manifests itself in the subject’s readiness to use p as a premise of practical or theoretical reasoning without hesitation (Unger 1975: 116). Of course, this aspect of psychological certainty is not in conflict with the characterization of this attitude outlined above. As a matter of fact, if any doubt regarding p’s truth is excluded for a subject, it is plausible that she is ready to use p as a premise of reasoning without hesitation.

While the characterization of psychological certainty just outlined capture central features of this attitude, it also faces certain difficulties. Given such a characterization of psychological certainty, one could be led to think, following Unger, that psychological certainty is a fundamentally dogmatic attitude which should not be adopted (Unger 1975). Yet, philosophers such as Dicker, Carrier, Douven and Olders reject the idea that psychological certainty consists of a dogmatic attitude (Dicker 1974: 166, 168, Carrier 1983, Douven and Olders 2008: 248) and philosophers such as Miller argue that psychological certainty is in fact compatible with a feeling of doubt (Miller 1978: 48, 53-54).

c. The Operational Model

As noted in the previous section, explicating the notion of psychological certainty in terms of an internally discernable feeling of conviction raises serious problems. This has led several philosophers to favor an operationalist or functionalist approach of psychological certainty. According to De Finetti, an operational definition of a subject’s degree of belief can be given in terms of her betting behavior (De Finetti 1937 and 1990). More precisely, a subject’s degree of belief in p can be conceived of as the odd that a subject regards as fair for a bet on p’s truth that would be rewarded with one monetary unit if p was true. For instance, suppose one is offered a bet on whether or not the proposition “Berlin is the capital of the Federal Republic of Germany” is true. Suppose, in addition, that if one were to be right concerning that proposition, one would be rewarded $1. If one is ready to pay $.80 to bet on the truth of that proposition, then, given De Finetti’s model, one’s degree of belief in the proposition “Berlin is the capital of the Federal Republic of Germany” can be represented as a function which assigns the value .8 to that proposition.

Ramsey generalizes the relationship between a subject’s expectations—her degree of belief regarding the truth of a set of propositions—and her behavior to any type of preferences (Ramsey 1929). According to him, whenever a subject determines whether she prefers to do A or B, she relies on her degree of belief in the propositions representing the states of affairs which the possible results of each option depends on. Thus, a subject’s expectations allow her to determine the value she can expect from each option and to rationally determine whether or not she prefers to do A or B.

Several representation theorems have been formulated to show that if a subject’s preferences satisfy a set of intuitively acceptable constraints, they can be represented by a probability function corresponding to both the subject’s expectations and a utility function which, in conjunction, maximize the expected utility of each possible option (Ramsey 1926, Savage 1954, Jeffrey 1965, Joyce 1999). This formalization of the relationship between rational expectations and rational preferences is central to both Bayesian Epistemology and Bayesian Decision Theory as it lays the groundwork for an analysis of epistemic rationality in light of the assumption that rational expectations can be represented as a probability distribution over a given set of propositions.

The connection between a subject’s degree of belief and her preferences suggests that psychological certainty can be conceived of as a subject’s propensity to act in a certain way. If one relies on betting behavior to explicate degree of belief, psychological certainty could be conceived of as a subject’s readiness to accept any bet concerning p’s truth as long as the bet at issue can result in potential gains. Such a conception would be similar to the one presented in the previous section; viewing psychological certainty as an attitude toward p characterized by the exclusion of doubt regarding p’s truth. If doubt regarding p’s truth is excluded for a subject, what reason could that subject have to refuse a bet on p’s truth that could result in potential gains? If any doubt regarding p’s truth is excluded for her, then nothing could lead her to doubt that p is true; not even the stakes involved in a particular bet concerning p’s truth.

But, of course, we are not certain of many propositions in that sense. If the stakes related to a bet that is offered to us concerning the truth of a proposition we regard as being certain are high, we hesitate. Additionally, it seems that we are right not to be certain of many propositions in that sense, for the evidence we normally have access to does not warrant adopting such an attitude. This is not perceived, however, as being fundamentally problemmatic by the proponents of Bayesian conceptions of epistemic and practical rationality as such conceptions purport to model epistemic and practical rationality in a context of generalized uncertainty. If such conceptions fundamentally aim at showing how it can be reasonable for a subject to think or act in certain way in a context of generalized uncertainty, the fact that given these conceptions there is almost nothing which we are certain and can reasonably be certain of can hardly count as a drawback. This is true as long as one is ready to concede that this construal of psychological certainty is not necessarily equivalent to our ordinary concept of psychological certainty (Jeffrey 1970: 161).

3. Epistemic Certainty

a. The Problem of Epistemic Certainty

According to the Lockean principle, which requires that one proportions one’s degree of belief to the evidence, a subject is justified in being psychologically certain of a proposition if, and only if, this proposition is epistemically certain. This principle is widely accepted as it explains why statements such as “It is certain that p, but I’m not certain that p” sound incoherent (Stanley 2008, Beddor 2020b, Vollet 2020). The main question being: are there epistemically certain propositions, and if so, what grounds their epistemic certainty?

To tackle this question, let us consider the following propositions:

(1)   It will rain in Paris in exactly one month at 5 p.m.

(2)   The lottery ticket I’ve just bought is a losing ticket (Context: It only has a chance of one in a million to win).

(3)   My car is currently parked in the parking lot (Context: I parked my car in the parking lot five minutes ago.)

(4)   The world was not created five minutes ago.

(5)   It hurts. (Context: I just dropped a hammer on my foot)

(6)   All bachelors are unmarried men.

As previously mentioned, epistemic certainty is relative to the epistemic position of a particular subject. Considering the six propositions above, the question at hand is therefore whether or not a subject’s epistemic position can be such that these propositions are certain for her. One can reasonably doubt that a subject can be in an epistemic position such that (1) is certain for her. Considering the evidence a subject normally has access to, it seems that (1) can be, at best, highly probable, but not certain. Likewise, (2) appears to constitute a typical example of uncertain propositions; the sort that tends to illustrate the difference between certainty and high probability.

On the other hand, it is intuitive to think that propositions such as (3), (4), (5) or (6) can be epistemically certain. In a typical situation, if a subject comes to doubt that her car is still parked in the spot she left it five minutes ago, that the world was not created five minutes ago, that it hurts when she drops a hammer on her foot, or that all bachelors are unmarried, one would presumably consider this doubt as ill-founded and absurd. Yet, one might think it is possible that one’s car was stolen two minutes ago, or that the world was created five minutes ago. In fact, it is unclear if the evidence one possesses allows dismissing such scenarios. What about propositions such as (5) and (6)? Some philosophers suggest that it is reasonable to doubt the truth of such propositions in cases where one is offered a bet with extremely high stakes, for example a bet in which, if the proposition is false, one’s family is tortured to death. In such cases, it seems reasonable to decline the bet. Now, given the Lockean principle mentioned above, this may be interpreted as providing good evidence to think that even these kinds of propositions are not actually certain.

These considerations show how problemmatic the notion of epistemic certainty can be. We easily admit that, given the evidence normally available to a subject, propositions such as (1) and (2) are uncertain. In contrast, we are inclined to think that propositions such as (3), (4), (5) and (6) are, or can be, epistemically certain. Yet, minimal reflection suffices to put this inclination into question. This has been highlighted by Hume; when one does not pay specific enough attention, one considers many propositions to be certain (Hume Treatise III, 1. 1. 1.). However, minimal philosophical reflection suffices to shake this conviction which reappears as soon as one comes back to one’s daily life. The question of the nature, possibility and extension of epistemic certainty is in fact nothing other than the problem of skepticism, which rests at the heart of important debates in epistemology (Firth 1967).

The challenge, then, consists in articulating and defending a criterion for epistemic certainty, while also explaining the problemmatic cases which arise from this criterion. If we consider the propositions (1)-(6), three families of theories of epistemic certainty can be distinguished.

In the following list, the term “skeptical” is used with respect to epistemic certainty, rather than knowledge:

  Skeptical:

o        Radically skeptical: none of the considered propositions are, or can be, certain.

o        Strongly skeptical: only propositions such as (6) are, or can be, certain.

o        Moderately skeptical: only propositions such as (5) or (6) are, or can be, certain.

Moderate:

o        Strong moderate: only propositions such as (4), (5) and (6) are, or can be, certain.

o        Weak moderate: only propositions such as (3), (4), (5) and (6) are, or can be, certain.

Weak:

o        Propositions such as  (2), (3), (4), (5) and (6) are, or can be, certain.

In the remaining sections, the focus is on the theories listed above, with radically skeptical theories considered as opponents that these theories are designed to respond to.

b. Skeptical Theories of Epistemic Certainty

i. Radical Infallibilism

One way of explaining epistemic certainty appeals to infallibility. In general, one is infallible with regard to p if and only if it is impossible for one to be mistaken about p’s truth (Audi 2003: 301 sq):

Certainty-RI: p is certain for S if, and only if, S can believe that p, and it is absolutely impossible for S to believe that p and to be mistaken about p’s truth.

According to this definition, at least two kinds of propositions can be certain. First, there are necessarily true propositions such as (6). Indeed, if a proposition is necessarily true, it is impossible for a subject to believe that this proposition is true and, at the same time, to be mistaken about that proposition’s truth. Second, there are propositions that are true in virtue of being believed to be so by a subject. For example, a subject cannot believe the propositions, “I have a belief” or, “I think, therefore I am” to be true and, at the same time, be mistaken concerning their truth. This is because, these propositions are true in virtue of being believed to be so by the subject.

As it should be clear, this conception of epistemic certainty excludes propositions such as (1), (2), (3), (4) and (5). Indeed, these propositions are contingent, and their truth is independent of whether or not they are believed to be true by a subject (Ayer 1956: 19). Certainty-RI is therefore a strongly skeptical conception of epistemic certainty. Given that conception, very few informative propositions can be certain or even known if one maintains that knowledge requires epistemic certainty.

A major difficulty raised by this conception of epistemic certainty is, however, that it entails that any logically or metaphysically necessary proposition is epistemically certain. For instance, a mathematical conjecture such as Goldbach’s, if it is true, is necessarily true. As a result, according to this conception of epistemic certainty, any mathematical conjecture, if it is true, is epistemically certain. Yet, it seems clear that one can have reasons to doubt the truth of a mathematical conjecture (Plantinga 1993: ch. 8).For example, a recognized expert might wrongly assert that a given conjecture is false. A related worry is the well-known problem of logical omniscience: since we are not logically omniscient, it is implausible to consider that every logical or metaphysical truth is certain for us (Hintikka 1962, Stalnaker 1991). In order for a logical or metaphysical necessity to be epistemically certain for a subject, it seems that the subject should at least grasp the nature of that necessity.

One crucial aspect that this conception of epistemic certainty fails to capture is related to the absence of good reasons to doubt. Intuitively, what makes a logical or metaphysical truth epistemically certain is not the fact that it is necessarily true, but that we have very strong reasons to regard it as necessarily true.

ii. Invariantist Maximalism

The above considerations suggest that epistemic certainty should rather be explicated in terms of the absence of good reasons to doubt:

Certainty-IND: p is certain for S if and only if p is epistemically indubitable for S. That is, if and only if it is impossible for S to have a good reason to doubt that p.

According to a first version of Certainty-IND, epistemic certainty depends on a subject having the highest possible degree of justification for believing a proposition (Russell 1948, Firth 1967: 8-12). If a subject’s justification is absolutely maximal with respect to p, no proposition q can be more justified than p. It follows that if p is certain, no proposition can provide a good reason to doubt that p, as any consideration q speaking against the truth of p would have a lower degree of justification. Let us label this conception “Invariantist Maximalism.”

Certainty-IM: p is epistemically certain for S if and only if there is no proposition q which can be more justified, for S, than p.

Invariantist Maximalism relies on the thought that the term “certain” is an absolute term which applies in light of an invariant and maximal criterion: if p is certain for S, nothing can be more certain than p, no matter the context of epistemic appraisal (Unger 1975. For criticisms, see Barnes 1973, Cargile 1972, Klein 1981, Stanley 2008, and Vollet 2020). An advantage of this view is that it does not entail that all necessary truths are epistemically certain. Even if one assumes that if a proposition is maximally justified for a subject, the subject is then infallible with respect to it, infallibility, on its own, is not sufficient for epistemic certainty. (Fantl and McGrath 2009: ch. 1, Firth 1967: 9). For example, someone cannot incorrectly believe that water is H2O, though one’s justification for believing that water is H2O need not be maximal.

Nonetheless, Invariantist Maximalism easily leads to radical skepticism. A first reason for this is that one might think it is impossible to identify a maximal threshold of justification. Indeed, it always seems possible to raise the degree of justification one has for believing that a given proposition is true, either by acquiring new evidence from a different source, or by acquiring higher-order justification (Brown 2011; 2018, Fantl 2003). Taking this into account, the invariantist Maximalist conception of epistemic certainty predicts that no proposition is epistemically certain.

Furthermore, this approach leads one to classify as epistemically uncertain any proposition less justified than those such as, “I exist.” This is the case even with propositions that can be logically deduced from such propositions. For, it is plausible that the degree of justification one has for believing logically stronger propositions than “I exist” is slightly lower than the degree of justification one has for believing the proposition “I exist”.

One way of avoiding these skeptical consequences is to restrict the set of propositions that constitute the comparison class. That is, the set of propositions which p is compared to in determining its epistemic certainty (see Firth 1967: 12 for a presentation of various possibilities). However, the difficulty is to propose a criterion for restricting this set that is neither too strong nor too weak. For instance, Chisholm proposes to restrict the comparison class to the propositions that a subject, at a given time t, can reasonably believe (Chisolm 1976: 27):

Certainty-Chisholm 1: p is certain for S at t if and only if

(i) Accepting p is more reasonable for S at t than withholding p, and

(ii) there is no q such that accepting q is more reasonable for S at t than accepting q.

Yet, this criterion seems too weak. If no proposition is justified to a high degree, some propositions with a very low degree of justification could be said to be epistemically certain given Certainty-Chisholm 1 (Reed 2008).

Consequently, consider the criterion proposed by Chisholm (1989: 12):

Certainty-Chisholm 2: p is epistemically certain for S if and only if, for any proposition q:

(i) believing p is more justified for S than withholding judgement concerning q, and

(ii) believing p is at least as justified for S as is believing q.

Even if this criterion is stronger, the problem is that there are many propositions which one has absolutely no evidence for, and, accordingly, concerning which one is absolutely justified to suspend judgement. For instance, it does not seem more reasonable to believe the proposition, “I think, therefore I am” than it is to withhold judgement concerning the proposition, “There are an even number of planets.” As a result, according to Certainty-Chisholm 2, “I think, therefore I am” is not epistemically certain (Reed 2008).

iii. Classical Infallibilism

According to another version of Certainty-IND, epistemic certainty does not require having a maximal justification for believing a proposition (in contrast to Certainty-IM) or being infallible regarding a proposition’s truth in the sense of Certainty-RI. Instead, epistemic certainty requires that one’s justification be infallible. To say that the justification S has for p is infallible is to say that it is impossible, logically or metaphysically, for S to have this justification and that p is false. In addition, this requirement is traditionally understood along internalist lines in such a way that whenever a subject possesses an infallible justification for p she is in a position, because of the access she has to the justifiers, to rule out, herself, the possibility of p being false. Thus, consider the following formulation of the classical infallibilist conception of epistemic certainty:

Certainty-CI: p is certain for S if and only if S has (internal) access to a justification for p which implies p.

According to this conception, epistemic certainty requires an infallible guarantee that is (reflexively) accessible to the subject (Dutant 2015). For instance, Descartes maintains that clear and distinct ideas are guaranteed to be true, and they are therefore epistemically indubitable (Meditations II). Russell states that through introspection, one can directly access one’s sense data, and that thereby, one’s introspective beliefs are guaranteed to be true (Russell 1912).

This kind of approach can avoid the problem of propositions that are necessarily true, but epistemically uncertain. This is the case if one maintains that one consideration can justify another only if what makes the first consideration true also (in part) makes the other consideration true (Fumerton 2005: sec. 2.2). Alternatively, one can think of an infallible guarantee as a ground or method of belief formation which cannot produce false beliefs (Dutant 2016). Note that this conception can allow propositions of type (5) to be certain if it is assumed, for example, that what justifies my belief that “My foot hurts” is the fact that my foot itself hurts, which is accessible via introspection.

The Bayesian approach, on a standard interpretation, can be considered as a formalized version of such a conception. One of its main tenets is that a subject’s expectations regarding a set of propositions can be, if rational, represented as a probability distribution over this set. In other words, a subject’s expectations relative to the truth of a set of propositions can be, if rational, represented as a function assigning to each of these propositions a numerical value which satisfies the definition of a probability function given by Kolmogorov (Kolmogorov 1956). If a subject’s rational expectations regarding a set of propositions are represented as such, the expectations a subject should have, given the evidence she possesses, can be represented in terms of conditional probability, whose definition is provided by Bayes’ theorem. Epistemic certainty is thus conceived of as the maximal probability (probability 1) that a proposition can have, given the available evidence:

Certainty-Prob: p is epistemically certain for S if and only if Pr(p|E) = 1

This conception of certainty can be viewed as a version of classical infallibilism if it is assumed that no false proposition can be evidence, that evidence is always accessible as such to the subject, and that whatever constitutes the evidence possessed by a subject is itself epistemically certain. This is a strongly skeptical conception if, following orthodox Bayesians like Jeffrey, one thinks that only logically necessary propositions should receive maximal probability (Jeffrey 2004). If, on the other hand, some contingent propositions, in particular about our own mental states, can be considered as evidence in this sense, then this conception can be regarded as moderately skeptical. The main advantage of this kind of approach is that it offers a way of accounting for practical and epistemic rationality in absence of epistemic certainty (and knowledge) of a great number of propositions.

Still, we may think we can have reasons to doubt the evidence we have and what our evidence does or does not entail (Lasonen-Aanio 2020). For example, one may have reason to doubt the infallible character of clear and distinct perceptions, or doubt what qualifies as clear and distinct (Descartes Meditations I, Ayer 1956: 42-44). Furthermore, the standard Bayesian conception has it that it is rational to take a bet on any logical truth, no matter the stakes or the odds. According to this framework, it would be irrational (probabilistically incoherent) to assign a non-maximal probability to a logical truth. Yet, it seems that it is sometimes irrational to take such a bet (Fantl and McGrath 2009: ch. 1, Hawthorne 2004). As previously demonstrated, it is plausible to think that some logical truths can be epistemically uncertain.

iv. A Worry for Skeptical Theories of Certainty

Whether or not a satisfactory skeptical account of certainty can be offered, it is in tension with our intuitive judgements and the ordinary way in which we use the word ‘certainty’ and epistemic modals (Huemer 2007, Beddor 2020b, Vollet 2020). Suppose that it is epistemically certain that p if and only if it is epistemically impossible that not-p (DeRose 1998). According to Invariantist Maximalism, for example, if I lost my wallet this morning and my wife tells me, “It might be in the restaurant” and I answer “No, that’s impossible, I didn’t go to the restaurant.” then, my wife says something which is, strictly speaking, true, and I say something which is, strictly speaking, false. Indeed, I do not satisfy the absolutely maximal criteria of justification with respect to the proposition, “My wallet is not in the restaurant.” Similarly, if my evidence does not logically exclude this possibility, then the probability of that proposition on my evidence is lower than 1. Even more surprisingly, we should admit that my wife would, strictly speaking, say something true were she to say “Your wallet might be on the Moon.” (Huemer 2007).

A pragmatic explanation of the (in)appropriateness of these utterances might be advanced. One might say that, in the above context, it is (practically) appropriate to ignore the epistemic possibilities in question (see the treatment of concessive knowledge attributions above). Still, explaining the intuitive (in)appropriateness of an utterance does not amount to accounting for its intuitive truth value. Another option is to rely on the distinction between epistemic and moral or practical certainty (Descartes Principles of philosophy, IV, § 205, Wedgwood 2012, Locke 2015). The latter can be understood as a degree of epistemic justification sufficiently high to treat the proposition as certain in one’s actions and practical decisions. One may suggest that the ordinary way in which people use ‘certain’ and the associated epistemic modals, as well as our intuitions, primarily tracks certainty as understood in the latter sense (Kattsoff 1965: 264).

The Bayesian approach has the advantage of providing a general framework in which practical and epistemic rationality in a context of generalized uncertainty can be modeled in a precise way. The claim that the subject’s expectations, if rational, can be represented as a probabilistic distribution allows formulating conditionalization rules describing exactly how a subject should adapt her expectations to the evidence in the absence of certainties. That said, either the concept of certainty that this approach uses is a technical one, in that it does not correspond to our ordinary concept of certainty, or this approach must provide an explanation of the way in which we ordinarily use this concept and the associated epistemic modals.

c. Moderate Theories of Epistemic Certainty

i. Moderate Infallibilism

It is often thought that requiring an infallible justification leads to skepticism about certainty (and knowledge). However, a non-skeptical and infallibilist account can be offered if one rejects the (internalist) accessibility requirement of Certainty-CI (Dutant 2016). For example, one could say that infallibility should not be cashed out in terms of the evidence possessed by a subject but instead in terms of a modal relation between the belief and the truth of its propositional content, such as the sensitivity of a belief or its safety (Dretske 1971, Nozick 1981, Williamson 2000). A reliabilist could also maintain that epistemic certainty requires that the belief-forming processes be maximally reliable (in the circumstances in which the belief is formed). Such approaches are infallibilist in the sense that they state it is impossible for a belief to be false if the guarantee (sensitivity, safety or maximal reliability) required for a proposition to be certain holds.

Another option consists in maintaining that infallibility depends on the subject’s evidence, while also opting for a more generous view of evidence. One may hold that propositions such as (4) can be certain if one thinks that the set of evidence a subject possesses can include any propositions about the external world (see Brown 2018 ch. 3 for further discussion). This option will typically exclude propositions such as (2), whose epistemic probability, although high, is not maximal. It can be declined in a stronger or weaker version, depending on whether propositions such as (3) can receive a maximal probability on the evidence.

Williamson defends a weak version of moderate infallibilism about knowledge, according to which one can know a proposition such as (3) (Williamson 2000). In addition to a safety condition allowing for a margin of error — in which a subject knows that p only if p is true in relevantly close situations — Williamson proposes that the evidence of a subject is only constituted by what she knows (see also McDowell 1982). If epistemic certainty is evidential probability 1, it follows that:

Certainty-Prob/K: p is epistemically certain for S if and only if Pr(p|K) = 1, where K stands for the set of propositions known by S.

This view is part of a broader “knowledge-first” research program in which Williamson assumes that (the concept of) knowledge is primitive. If this approach is correct, it can provide a reductive analysis of epistemic certainty in terms of knowledge by considering that all and only known propositions (or all and only propositions one is in a position to know) are epistemic certainties. This fits well with the traditional view of epistemic modals, according to which “It is impossible that p” (and, therefore, “It is certain that not-p”) is true if and only if p is incompatible with what the subject (or a potentially contextually determined relevant group of subjects) knows, or is in a position to know (DeRose 1991).

However, one can subscribe to a moderately infallibilist view of certainty without subscribing to the claim that knowledge entails certainty. As a matter of fact, the very idea that knowledge is moderately infallible is controversial. According to a widespread view, often called “logical fallibilism about knowledge,” S can know that p even if S’ evidence does not entail that p, or even if prob(p|E) is less than one (Cohen 1988, Rysiew 2001, Reed 2002, Brown 2011, 2018, Fantl and McGrath 2009: chap. 1). In some versions, this kind of fallibilism concedes that knowing that p requires having entailing evidence for p, but rejects that all evidence must be maximally probable (Dougherty 2011: 140). According to this fallibilist view of knowledge, propositions such as (2) can typically be known. However, proponents of this view generally deny that propositions such as (2), — and, even, propositions such as (3), (4), (5) or (6) — can be certain. Therefore, logical fallibilism about knowledge is compatible with a moderately infallibilist conception of epistemic certainty, in which epistemic certainty requires that a subject’s evidence entails that p, or that p’s epistemic probability be maximal (Reed 2008, Dougherty 2011). In brief, logical fallibilism about knowledge states that p can be known even if p is not epistemically certain, even in the sense of the moderate infallibilist view of certainty.

Regardless of if one endorses logical fallibilism about knowledge, a moderate infallibilist view of certainty which relies on a generous account of evidence accepts that p is epistemically certain for S if and only if S’ evidence rules out all the possibilities in which p is false, where a possibility is “ruled out” by evidence when it is logically incompatible with it (or with the fact that S has this evidence: Lewis 1996). According to this approach, the certainty conferring evidence must have probability 1 and be true, otherwise, the entailed proposition could be false and receive a probability lower than 1 (Brown 2018: 28). If one endorses logical fallibilism about knowledge, then epistemic certainties are a subset of what the subject knows, or is in a position to know (Littlejohn 2011, Petersen 2019, Beddor 2020b, Vollet 2020).

A general concern for this type of approach is that it can seem circular or insufficient. Indeed, the propositions (evidence) that grant epistemic certainty must themselves be epistemically certain. If not, what can be deduced from them will not be certain. Therefore, according to such approaches, one must assume that there are primitive epistemic certainties, that is, propositions whose prior probability is 1 (Russell 1948, Van Cleve 1977). However, the question remains: in virtue of what do these propositions have such a high probability? In addition, as logical truths are logically entailed by any set of evidence, this approach fails to account for the fact that logical truths can be epistemically uncertain.

ii. Fallibilism

According to other philosophers, while epistemic certainty depends on the evidence a subject has, that evidence does not need to entail that p in order for p to be certain. To express that claim in terms of epistemic probability: the probability of p being true conditional on the evidence possessed by a subject does not need to be maximal for p to be epistemically certain for that subject (see Reed 2002: 145-146 for further discussion).

According to Moore, if S knows that p, then it is epistemically impossible for S that p is false (Moore 1959). In other words, p is epistemically certain for S. However, in Moore’s view, one can know that p based on evidence that does not entail p’s truth. For instance, a subject can know that she has hands based on a visual experience of her hands so that it is epistemically impossible for her, given that experience, that she does not have hands. Yet, it is logically possible for the subject to undergo that visual experience without having hands. The logical possibility of undergoing that experience without having hands is simply conceived of by Moore as being compatible with the epistemic certainty regarding the fact that she has hands (see also DeRose 1991, Stanley 2005b). Thus, Moore offers a fallibilist conception of certainty based on a fallibilist conception of knowledge.

According to Moore’s conception of epistemic certainty, propositions such as (3) or (4) can be certain provided that their negation is incompatible with what a subject knows and propositions such as (5) can be uncertain if their negation is compatible with what a subject knows. In addition, this framework opens up the possibility of a weak conception of epistemic certainty, according to which propositions such as (2) can be epistemically certain.

In Moore’s approach, epistemic certainty is identified with knowledge. Nevertheless, Moore himself acknowledges that one may want to draw a distinction between knowledge and certainty (see also Firth 1967: 10, Miller 1978: 46n3, Lehrer, 1974, Stanley 2008). As previously noted, it is common to draw such a distinction by endorsing a logical fallibilist conception of knowledge, while also maintaining an infallibilist (either moderate or skeptical) conception of certainty. But is it possible to endorse, with Moore, a fallibilist conception of epistemic certainty and still draw a distinction between knowledge and epistemic certainty?

That is possible if one endorses another version of fallibilism with respect to knowledge, which is known as epistemic fallibilism. According to epistemic fallibilism, S can know that p even if S cannot rule out every possibility of p being false, where a possibility of p being false is “ruled out” whenever it is logically incompatible with what S knows to be true (Dretske 1981: 371). Endorsing such a conception of knowledge involves rejecting epistemic closure in that it involves accepting that S can know that p, and that p entails q, without thereby knowing (or being in a position to know) whether q is true. It involves accepting that S can know that she has hands, and that her having hands entails that she is not a handless brain in a vat, without thereby being in a position to know whether she is a handless brain in a vat (Nozick 1981, Dretske 1970).

Thus, even if one endorses a logical fallibilist conception of epistemic certainty, one can maintain that, in contrast to knowledge, certainty requires epistemic infallibility in this sense. That is, epistemic certainty requires having a justification for p such that every possibility of p being false is ruled out. This can be seen by the fallibilist conception of epistemic certainty in terms of immunity, as presented below. Given this approach, it is possible to claim that propositions such as (2) can be known, while also claiming that they cannot be epistemically certain. Though a subject can know that her lottery ticket is a losing one, it is not certain to her that it is a losing ticket. Indeed, the justification that the subject has for her belief does not rule out any possibility that her ticket is a winning one.

Another way to draw a distinction between knowledge and epistemic certainty which is compatible with a fallibilist conception of epistemic certainty is to argue that certainty involves, in addition to knowing a particular proposition to be true, having a specific epistemic perspective on that knowledge. For instance, Descartes acknowledges the fact that an atheist mathematician can possess a cognitio of mathematical truths but claims that she could not possess a scientia of that domain (Descartes Meditations on First Philosophy, second answer to objections). As such, an atheist mathematician does not recognize the divine guarantee that anything which is conceived of clearly and distinctly is thereby true. Thus, whenever she conceives mathematical truths clearly and distinctly, she cannot know that she knows. Accordingly, her knowledge of mathematical truths remains uncertain (Carrier 1993). Likewise, Williamson endorses the idea that a form of epistemic uncertainty can result from a lack of second-order knowledge (Williamson 2005; 2009, Rysiew 2007: 636-37, 657–58, n. 13, Turri 2010).

iii. Epistemic Immunity and Incorrigibility

According to moderate conceptions of epistemic certainty, propositions such as (3) or (4) can be certain for a subject. This is because either these propositions can be deduced from other propositions which are themselves certain, or the justification one has for these propositions is, although fallible, sufficient for certainty. Yet, if certainty depends on neither complete infallibility, nor on maximal justification, what does it depend on, precisely? What makes propositions such as (3) and (4), or the propositions from which they can be deduced from, certain for a subject?

The plausibility of strong conceptions of epistemic certainty results, at least partly, from the fact that they attribute a type of epistemic immunity to propositions which are certain. As previously noted, if a proposition p is maximally justified for a subject, then that proposition is immune to refutation. This is because there is no proposition q, such that q is incompatible with p, which can defeat or diminish p’s justification. A proposition also seems to be immune to refutation so long as the evidence one has for that proposition is itself infallible. One aim of moderate conceptions of epistemic certainty is therefore to offer a conception of epistemic certainty that attributes a form of epistemic immunity to propositions which are considered certain, without making this immunity dependent on complete infallibility or maximal justification.

Incorrigibility consists of a type of epistemic immunity that depends neither on complete infallibility, nor on maximal justification. The justification one has for p is considered incorrigible if it constitutes an ultimate authority on the question as to whether p and it cannot be defeated (Ayer 1963: 70-73, Firth 1967: 21, Alston 1992, Reed 2002: 144). Propositions concerning one’s mental states– such as one’s intentions, feelings, thoughts and immediate experiences– are typical examples of propositions for which one can have an incorrigible justification (Malcolm 1963: 77-86; Ayer 1963: 68-73, Firth 1967: 21). For instance, if a subject sincerely asserts that she undergoes an experience of something as of being red, this assertion seems to provide an incorrigible justification for the proposition “That subject undergoes an experience of something being red” (see Armstrong 1963 for a critical discussion).

However, that the justification one has for such a proposition is incorrigible does not entail that the proposition which is thus justified is true (Ayer 1963: 71-73). For, incorrigibility does not require infallibility (Firth 1967: 25). Some philosophers suggest that with respect to our own mental states, the incorrigibility of the justification we have for a proposition such as ‘I am in pain’ depends on the fact that we are infallible regarding our mental states (Malcolm 1963: 85). On the contrary, one can suppose that incorrigibility results from enjoying a privileged, yet fallible access to our mental states. For example, if I consider two lines of similar length, I can wonder which line appears to be the longest. If I can doubt this particular appearance, then I can consider being wrong about it. I can also falsely believe that the second line appears to be longer than the first one (Ayer 1956: 65). Additionally, incorrigible justification does not require maximal justification. In a world where no one can be wrong about their mental states, propositions concerning one’s mental states would be better justified if asserted sincerely. This suggests that, in the actual world, the incorrigible justification one has for such propositions is not maximal.

According to this approach, propositions about the external world such as (4) are considered epistemically certain. This is because it seems unreasonable to question the truth of propositions such as ”The world was not created five minutes ago”, “The external world exists” or “I have hands.” According to hinge theorists following Wittgenstein, the position of such propositions within one’s conceptual scheme is what makes them immune or incorrigible, and thereby certain (Wittgenstein 1969, Coliva 2015, Pritchard 2016). The truth of these propositions must be assumed in order to be able to operate with the notions of doubt and justification. Outside of very specific contexts, such as those involving someone who lost her hands in an accident, attempting to justify or doubt the truth of having hands is simply nonsensical. In Wittgenstein’s view, this incorrigibility is what distinguishes knowable propositions from certain propositions; the former can be the object of doubt and justification, while the latter cannot.

Another approach proposes that propositions about the external world can be certain even if all their logical consequences have not been verified, so long as their justification is sufficiently immune (contra C. I. Lewis 1946: 80, 180). A specification of sufficient immunity relies on the concept of ideal irrefutability. A proposition p is ideally irrefutable at a time t for a subject S if and only if there is no conceivable event such that if at t S is justified in believing that this event will occur, S is also justified in believing that p is false at t (Firth 1967: 16). In other words, a proposition p is certain if and only if one is justified in believing that p and, for all future tests which one is justified in believing that they will happen (or that one could imagine), they are such that they would not provide a justification for believing that p is false (Malcolm 1963: 68).

For example, suppose I see that there is an ink bottle here. This is compatible with the possibility of me having the future sensation of my hand passing through the ink bottle. I may even be justified in believing I will undergo such a sensation (suppose, for example, that a reliable prediction has been made). Yet, there is a way in which the present sensation of there being an ink bottle here justifies treating, at the moment of my seeing, any future sensation indicating that there is not an ink bottle here as misleading. After all, for any future such sensation, there exists a possible explanation that is compatible with the claim ”There is an ink bottle here.” For example, a future sensation of my hand passing through the ink bottle might be explained as a hallucination. If I am, at the moment of my seeing, justified in believing that there is actually an ink bottle here, it seems that, at that very moment, I am also justified in believing that any future sensation is explainable in a way that is compatible with the claim ”There is an ink-bottle here”. If so, at the moment of my seeing, the proposition that there is an ink-bottle here can be said to be ideally irrefutable and, according to the view of epistemic certainty under examination, epistemically certain for me.

Note that this does not mean the propositions that are epistemically certain for S in the present will remain epistemically certain for S in the future. If, in the future, S has the sensation that her hand passes through the ink bottle and her vision of the ink bottle is different, the proposition “There is, or was, an ink-bottle here” can become epistemically uncertain for S (Klein 1981: 91). What matters here is that, at the moment of S’s seeing that there is an ink bottle, S is justified in believing any future sensation can be explained as compatible  with the claim ”There is an ink bottle here.”

In comparison, Miller defends a weaker account of immunity and certainty. According to him, the justification possessed by S makes p certain only if there can be no other proposition q which is justified enough to show that S should not believe p, in spite of S’ current reasons to believe p (Miller 1978). In other words, p is certain for S if it is always permissible for S to believe p in light of S’s current and future evidence. According to this view, it does not matter if the new evidence will make the belief that not-p permissible, or if the hypothesis that not-p will constitute the best available explanation for the new set of evidence. For example, suppose that a scientist and everyone around me say that there have never been cars, and that I’m just waking from a dream caused by drugs. If I add this experience to my memories of cars, it still seems permissible for me to believe that there are cars, and to doubt the testimony of the people telling me the contrary– even if I can find no good explanation for my new experience.

According to a stronger characterization of immunity, certainty requires the proposition p be ideally immune to any decrease in justification. In this sense, it is not clear that the proposition “There is an ink bottle here” is certain. For, it seems that if I was justified in believing that my hand will pass over the supposed ink bottle, my justification for believing that there is an ink bottle would diminish (Firth 1967: 17, Miller 1978, contra Malcolm 1963: 93).

A slightly different approach proposed by Klein also requires immunity against a decrease in justification (Klein 1981; 1992). According to him, p is absolutely certain for S if and only if (a) p is warranted for S, (b) S is warranted in denying every proposition q such that if q was added to S‘s beliefs, the warrant for p would be reduced (subjective immunity) and (c) there is no true proposition d, such that if d was added to S‘s true beliefs the warrant for p would be reduced (objective immunity).The satisfaction of condition (a) does not entail that p is true, for the set of justified beliefs can include false beliefs, but condition (c) can be satisfied only if p is true.

This approach proposes that epistemic certainty requires immunity against all attacks in the actual world, but not immunity against all attacks in all possible worlds (in particular, in the worlds in which the considered proposition is false). The fact that it is not certain (for S) that a proposition is certain, or the fact that this proposition is not certain in all possible worlds, does not make this proposition uncertain in the actual world (Klein 1981: 181-189).

One can apprehend the distinction between certainty in the actual world and certainty in all possible worlds with the notion of relative certainty. When speaking of relative certainty, one may want to characterize a degree of justification more or less close to absolute certainty in the actual world, which implies some uncertainty for the proposition in the actual world. But one may also want to designate a degree of justification more or less close to absolute certainty in all possible worlds. If, in this second sense, relative certainty implies uncertainty for the proposition in some possible worlds, it does not imply uncertainty for the proposition in the actual world (Klein 1981: 189).

Most theories of certainty based on the notion of epistemic immunity are strong moderate theories. They take p to be epistemically certain for S only if, for any contrary proposition q (which implies not-p or decreases the justification for p), S is permitted to deny q. Hence, these theories exclude that propositions such as (3) are certain, for it is not difficult to imagine a situation in which the police call you to say that your car was stolen. In such a situation, it does not seem that you are allowed to deny that your car has been stolen.

However, a question remains regarding the kind of certainty this approach assigns to propositions such as (4). In virtue of what would S be allowed to deny a contrary proposition q, for example, the proposition that the world was created five minutes ago and we were born two minutes ago with false memories? If it is in virtue of the fact that p is certain, it appears that immunity is a logical consequence of epistemic certainty, rather than its grounds (Klein 1981: 30, Reed 2008). If it is in virtue of the fact that p occupies a specific place in our conceptual or linguistic scheme (Wittgenstein 1969), or that one cannot imagine or conceive of a possible refutation or invalidation for p, it is not clear that the certainty attached to propositions such as (4) is epistemic, rather than merely psychological.

d. Weak Theories of Epistemic Certainty

i. The Relativity of Certainty

According to weak theories of certainty, propositions such as (2) can be certain. As outlined in the previous section, one may understand the notion of certainty in relation to a class of propositions justified or true in the actual world or in relation to a class of propositions justified or true in all possible worlds. Yet, there are many other ways of relativising the notion of certainty (Firth 1967: 10-12). For example, there are Chisholm’s views previously mentioned (Chisholm 1976, 1989). Malcolm suggests that there are various kinds of justification associated with different kinds of propositions, which can give rise to various criteria for certainty (Malcolm 1963). For instance, to see in full light that a given object is a plate seems to provide one with a maximally strong justification for believing that the object is a plate. That is because, according to Malcolm, no one “has any conception of what would be a better proof that it is a plate”  (Malcolm 1963: 92). Still, as Firth (1967: 19-20) notes, that depends on the criterion used to define “better.” (Firth 1967: 19-20) According to a Cartesian criterion, we would have a better justification in a world in which vision is infallible and our senses are never misleading. Although it is possible to defend a weak invariantist account of epistemic certainty, the fact that various criteria of epistemic certainty can be conceived of may suggest that these criteria are, in fact, shifty.

ii. Contextualism

A first way of elaborating the thought that the standards of certainty are shifty consists in suggesting that ascriptions of certainty are, with respect to their truth-conditions, context-sensitive (Lewis 1976: 353-354, Stanley 2008, Petersen 2019, Beddor 2020a, b, Vollet 2020). A theory of this kind has notably been defended regarding ascriptions of knowledge. On this view, the epistemic standards that a subject S must satisfy with respect to a proposition p for a statement such as “S knows that p” to be true, depends on the conversational context (Cohen 1988, Lewis 1996, DeRose 2009). Some relevant features of the context are the salience of various error possibilities, as well as possibilities that one must take into account given the stakes related to being wrong about p. In the same way as the question of whether S is tall cannot be answered without (implicitly) invoking a reference class, relative to which a standard is fixed (for instance, tall “for a basketball player” or “for a child”), the question of whether or not a proposition is certain might not be answerable independently of the context in which the word ‘certain’ is used. There could be contexts in which the statement, “It is certain that my lottery ticket is a losing ticket” is true, for example a context in which we are discussing the opportunity of making an important financial investment – and contexts where that statement is false, even if the evidential situation remains the same – for example a context where we are discussing the fact that at least one lottery ticket will be the winning one.

However, adopting a contextualist view of certainty does not suffice to vindicate a weak theory of certainty. For example, Beddor proposes that the ascription “It is (epistemically) certain for S that p” is true if and only if p is true in all the contextually relevant worlds compatible with S’s epistemic situation, where the space of contextually relevant worlds includes all worlds nearby the actual world. Under the assumption that there is always a nearby world where one’s ticket wins, (2) cannot, given such a view, qualify as certain (see also Lewis’ rule of resemblance, 1996: 557).

iii. Pragmatic Encroachment

Some authors claim that the epistemic standards a subject must satisfy to know a proposition are partially determined by the question as to whether it is rational for this subject to act on the proposition’s truth given her overall practical situation (Stanley 2005a, Hawthorne 2004, Fantl and McGrath 2009). One may suggest that this “pragmatic encroachment” concerns also, or rather, epistemic certainty. For example, Stanley argues for the existence of a pragmatic encroachment on knowledge and maintains that knowledge determines epistemic certainties, that is, the epistemic possibilities relative to which a proposition can be considered to be epistemically certain (Stanley 2005a). Fantl and McGrath, for their part, defend the existence of a pragmatic encroachment on knowledge-level justification but reject the claim that knowledge-level justification determines epistemic certainties (Fantl and McGrath 2009). A third option would be to reject pragmatic encroachment on knowledge as well as the idea that knowledge determines epistemic certainties, while allowing pragmatic encroachment on epistemic certainties.

The conceptions according to which the criteria of epistemic certainty shifts with the conversational context or the practical cost of error, are compatible with a weak conception of epistemic certainty. Indeed, they can easily grant that there are contexts in which one says something true when one says of a proposition like (2) that it is certain for S.

4. Connections to Other Topics in Epistemology

The notion of certainty is connected to various epistemological debates. In particular, it is connected to philosophical issues concerning norms of assertions, actions, beliefs and credences. It also concerns central questions regarding the nature of evidence, evidential probability, and the current debate regarding epistemic modals (Beddor 2020b).

For example, some philosophers distinguish knowledge and certainty and propose to deal with concessive knowledge attributions by embracing the view that certainty is the epistemic norm of assertion (Stanley 2008, Pertersen 2019, Beddor 2020b, Vollet 2020). A prominent argument for such a certainty norm of assertion comes from the infelicity of Moorean assertions involving certainty, such as, “p, but it’s not / I’m not certain that p.” In a similar vein, some philosophers defend a certainty norm of action and practical reasoning (Beddor 2020a, Vollet 2020). This is in part because such a norm can easily handle some of the counterexamples raised against competing knowledge norms (for such counterexamples, see Brown 2008, Reed 2010 and Roebert 2018; for an overview on knowledge norms, see Benton 2014).

For instance, Beddor argues that, with respect to the nature of evidence and evidential probability, we should analyze evidence in terms of epistemic certainty (Beddor 2020b). Such a view is supported by the oddity of the utterance, “It is certain that smoking causes cancer, but the evidence leaves open the possibility that smoking does not cause cancer.” This suggests that if p is epistemically certain, then p is entailed by the available evidence. In addition, the oddity of the utterance, “The medical evidence entails that smoking causes cancer, but it isn’t certain that smoking causes cancer” suggests that p is entailed by the available evidence only if p is epistemically certain.

Thus, given the relations it bears to other important philosophical notions, it is clear that certainty is central to epistemological theorizing. The difficulty of providing a fully satisfactory analysis of this notion might then suggest that certainty should, in fact, be treated as primitive.

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Author Information

Miloud Belkoniene
Email: miloud@belkoniene.org
University of Glasgow
United Kingdom

and

Jacques-Henri Vollet
Email: jacquesvollet@yahoo.fr
University Paris-Est Créteil
France

Epistemic Value

Epistemic value is a kind of value which attaches to cognitive successes such as true beliefs, justified beliefs, knowledge, and understanding. These kinds of cognitive success do often have practical value: true beliefs about local geography help us get to work on time; knowledge of mechanics allows us to build vehicles; understanding of general annual weather patterns helps us to plant our fields at the right time of year to ensure a good harvest. By contrast, false beliefs can and do lead us astray both in trivial and in colossally important ways.

It is fairly uncontroversial that we tend to care about having various cognitive or epistemic goods, at least for their practical value, and perhaps also for their own sakes as cognitive successes. But this uncontroversial point raises a number of important questions. For example, it is natural to wonder whether there really are all these different kinds of things (true beliefs, knowledge, and so on) which have distinct value from an epistemic point of view, or whether the value of some of them is reducible to, or depends on, the value of others.

It is also natural to think that knowledge is more valuable than mere true belief, but it has proven to be a challenge explaining where the extra value of knowledge comes from. Similarly, it is natural to think that understanding is more valuable than any other epistemic state which falls short of understanding, such as true belief or knowledge. But there is disagreement about what makes understanding the highest epistemic value, or what makes it distinctly valuable, or even whether it is distinctly valuable.

Indeed, it is no easy task saying just what makes something an epistemic value in the first place. Perhaps epistemic values just exist on their own, independent of other kinds of value? Or perhaps cognitive goods are valuable because we care about having them for their own sakes? Or perhaps they are valuable because they help us to achieve other things which we care about for their own sakes?

Furthermore, if we accept that there are things that are epistemically valuable, then we might be tempted to accept a kind of instrumental (or consequentialist, or teleological) conception of epistemic rationality or justification, according to which a belief is epistemically rational just in case it appropriately promotes the achievement of an epistemic goal, or it complies with rules which tend to produce overall epistemically valuable belief-systems. If this idea is correct, then we need to know which epistemic values to include in the formulation of the epistemic goal, where the epistemic goal is an epistemically valuable goal in light of which we evaluate beliefs as epistemically rational or irrational.

Table of Contents

1. Claims about Value
   1. Instrumental and Final Value
   2. Subjective and Objective Value
   3. Pro Tanto and All-Things-Considered Value
2. The Value Problem
   1. The Primary Value Problem
      1. Knowledge as Mere True Belief
      2. Stability
      3. Virtues
      4. Reliabilism
      5. Contingent Features of Knowledge
      6. Derivative Non-Instrumental Value
   2. The Secondary Value Problem
      1. No Extra Value
      2. Virtues
      3. Knowledge and Factive Mental States
      4. Internalism and the Basing Relation
   3. The Tertiary Value Problem
3. Truth and other Epistemic Values
   1. Truth Gets Us What We Want
   2. What People Ought to Care About
   3. Proper Functions
   4. Assuming an Epistemic Value/Critical Domains of Evaluation
   5. Anti-Realism
   6. Why the Focus on Truth?
4. Understanding
   1. Understanding: Propositions and Domains; Subjective and Objective
   2. The Location of the Special Value of Understanding
   3. The Value of Understanding
   4. Alternatives to the Natural Picture of the Value of Understanding
5. Instrumentalism and Epistemic Goals
   1. The Epistemic Goal as a Subset of the Epistemic Values
   2. Common Formulations of the Epistemic Goal
   3. Differences between the Goals: Interest and Importance
   4. Differences between the Goals: Synchronic and Diachronic Formulations
6. Conclusion
7. References and Further Reading

1. Claims about Value

Philosophers working on questions of value typically draw a number of distinctions which are good to keep in mind when we’re thinking about particular kinds of value claims. We’ll look at three particularly useful distinctions here before getting into the debates about epistemic value.

a. Instrumental and Final Value

The first important distinction to keep in mind is between instrumental and final value. An object (or state, property, and so forth) is instrumentally valuable if and only if it brings about something else that is valuable. An object is finally valuable if and only if it’s valuable for its own sake.

For example, it’s valuable to have a hidden pile of cash in your mattress: when you have a pile of cash readily accessible, you have the means to acquire things which are valuable, such as clothing, food, and so on. And, depending on the kind of person you are, it might give you peace of mind to sleep on a pile of cash. But piles of cash are not valuable for their own sake—money is obviously only good for what it can get you. So money is only instrumentally valuable.

By contrast, being healthy is something we typically think of as finally valuable. Although being healthy is instrumentally good because it enables us to do other valuable things, we also care about being healthy just because it’s good to be healthy, whether or not our state of health allows us to achieve other goods.

The existence of instrumental value depends on and derives from the existence of final value. But it’s possible for final value to exist without any instrumental value. There are possible worlds where there simply are no causal relations at all, for example. In some worlds like that, there could exist some final value (for instance, there could be sentient beings who feel great pleasure), but nothing would ever count as a means for bringing about anything else, and there would be no instrumental value. In the actual world, though, it’s pretty clear that there is both instrumental and final value.

b. Subjective and Objective Value

The second distinction is between subjective and objective value. Subjective value is a matter of the satisfaction of people’s desires (or the fulfillment of their plans, intentions, and so forth). Objective value is a kind of value which doesn’t depend on what people desire, care about, plan to do, and so forth. (To say that an object or event O is subjectively valuable for a subject S is not to say anything about why S thinks that O is valuable; O can be subjectively valuable in virtue of S’s desiring to bring O about, even if the reason S desires to bring O about is precisely because S thinks that O is objectively valuable. In a case like that, if O really is objectively valuable, then it is both objectively and subjectively valuable; but if S is mistaken, and O is not objectively valuable, then O is only subjectively valuable.)

Some philosophers think that there is really only subjective value (and correspondingly, subjective reasons, obligations, and so on); others think that there is only objective value, and that there is value in achieving one’s actual desires only when the desires are themselves objectively good. Still other philosophers allow both kinds of value. Many of the views which we’ll see below can be articulated in terms of either subjective or objective value, and when a view is committed to allowing only one type of value, the context will generally make it clear whether it’s subjective or objective. So, to keep things simple, claims about value will not be qualified as subjective or objective in what follows.

c. Pro Tanto and All-Things-Considered Value

Suppose that God declares that it is maximally valuable, always and everywhere, to feed the hungry. Assuming that God is omniscient and doesn’t lie, it necessarily follows that it’s true that it’s maximally valuable, always and everywhere, to feed the hungry. So there’s nothing that could ever outweigh the value of feeding the hungry. This would be an indefeasible kind of value: it is a kind of value that cannot be defeated by any contrary values or considerations.

Most value, however, is defeasible: it can be defeated, either by being overridden by contrary value-considerations, or else by being undermined. For an example of undermining: it’s instrumentally valuable to have a policy of getting an annual physical exam done, because that’s the kind of thing that normally helps catch medical issues before they become serious. But suppose that Sylvia becomes invulnerable to medically diagnosable illnesses. . In this case, nothing medically valuable comes about as a result of Sylvia’s policy of getting her physical done. The instrumental medical value which that policy would have enjoyed is undermined by the fact that annual physicals no longer contribute to keeping Sylvia in good health.

By contrast, imagine that Roger goes to the emergency room for a dislocated shoulder. The doctors fix his shoulder, but while sitting in the waiting room, Roger inhales droplets from another patient’s sneeze, and he contracts meningitis as a result, which ends up causing him brain damage. In this case, there is some medical value which resulted from Roger’s visit to the emergency room: his shoulder was fixed. But because brain damage is more disvaluable than a fixed shoulder is valuable, the value of having a fixed should is outweighed, or overridden, by the disvalue of having brain damage. So all things considered, Roger’s visit to the emergency room is disvaluable. But at least there is still something positive to be said for it.

In cases where some value V1 of an object O (or action, event, and so forth) is overridden by some contrary value V2, but where V1 still at least counts in favour of O’s being valuable, we can say that V1 is a pro tanto kind of value (that is, value “so far as it goes” or “to that extent”). So the value of Roger’s fixed shoulder is pro tanto: it counts in favour of the value of his visit to the emergency room, even though it is outweighed by the disvalue of his resulting brain damage. The disvalue of getting brain damage is also pro tanto: there can be contrary values which would outweigh it, though in Roger’s case, the disvalue of the brain damage is the stronger of the competing value-considerations. So we can say that, all things considered, Roger’s visit to the emergency room is disvaluable.

2. The Value Problem

a. The Primary Value Problem

Knowledge and true belief both tend to be things we want to have, but all else being equal, we tend to prefer to have knowledge over mere true belief. The “Primary Value Problem” is the problem of explaining why that should be the case. Many epistemologists think that we should take it as a criterion of adequacy for theories of knowledge that they be able to explain the fact that we prefer knowledge to mere true belief, or at least that they be consistent with a good explanation of why that should be the case.

To illustrate: suppose that Steve believes that the Yankees are a good baseball team, because he thinks that their pinstriped uniforms are so sharp-looking. Steve’s belief is true – the Yankees always field a good team – but he holds his belief for such a terrible reason that we are very reluctant to think of it as an item of knowledge.

Cases like that one motivate the view that knowledge consists of more than just true belief. In order to count as knowledge, a belief has to be well justified in some suitable sense, and it should also meet a suitable Gettier-avoidance condition (see the article on Gettier Problems). But not only do beliefs like Steve’s motivate the view that knowledge consists of more than mere true belief: they also motivate the view that knowledge is better to have than true belief. For suppose that Yolanda knows the Yankees’ stats, and on that basis she believes that the Yankees are a good team. It seems that Yolanda’s belief counts as an item of knowledge. And if we compare Steve and Yolanda, it seems that Yolanda is doing better than Steve; we’d prefer to be in Yolanda’s epistemic position rather than in Steve’s. This seems to indicate that we prefer knowledge over mere true belief.

The challenge of the Primary Value Problem is to explain why that should be the case. Why should we care about whether we have knowledge instead of mere true belief? After all, as is often pointed out, true beliefs seem to bring us the very same practical benefits as knowledge. (Steve would do just as well as Yolanda betting on the Yankees, for example.) Socrates makes this point in the Meno, arguing that if someone wants to get to Larisa, and he has a true belief but not knowledge about which road to take, then he will get to Larisa just as surely as if he had knowledge of which road to take. In response to Socrates’s argument, Meno is moved to wonder why anyone should care about having knowledge instead of mere true belief. (Hence, the Primary Value Problem is sometimes called the Meno Problem.)

So in short, the problem is that mere true beliefs seem to be just as likely as knowledge to guide us well in our actions. But we still seem to have the persistent intuition that there is something better about any given item of knowledge than the corresponding item of mere true belief. The challenge is to explain this intuition. Strategies for addressing this problem can either try to show that knowledge really is always more valuable than corresponding items of mere true belief, or else they can allow that knowledge is sometimes (or even always) no more valuable than mere true belief. If we adopt the latter kind of response to the problem, it is incumbent on us to explain why we should have the intuition that knowledge is more valuable than mere true belief, in cases where it turns out that knowledge isn’t in fact more valuable. Following Pritchard (2008; 2009), we can call strategies of the first kind vindicating, and we can call strategies of the second kind revisionary.

There isn’t a received view among epistemologists about how we ought to respond to the Primary Value Problem. What follows is an explanation of some important proposals from the literature, and a discussion of their challenges and prospects.

i. Knowledge as Mere True Belief

A very straightforward way to respond to the problem is to deny one of the intuitions on which the problem depends, the intuition that knowledge is distinct from true belief.  Meno toys with this idea in the Meno, though Socrates disabuses him of the idea. (Somewhat more recently, Sartwell (1991; 1992) has defended this approach to knowledge.) If knowledge is identical with true belief, then we can simply reject the value problem as resting on a mistaken view of knowledge. If knowledge is true belief, then there’s no discrepancy in value to explain.

The view that knowledge is just true belief is almost universally rejected, however. Cases where subjects have true beliefs but lack knowledge are so easy to construct and so intuitively obvious that identifying knowledge with true belief represents an extreme departure from what most epistemologists and laypeople think of knowledge. Consider once again Steve’s belief that the Yankees are a good baseball team, which he holds because he thinks their pinstriped uniforms are so sharp. It seems like an abuse of language to call Steve’s belief an item of knowledge. At the very least, we should be hesitant to accept such an extreme view until we’ve exhausted all other theoretical options.

It could still be the case that knowledge is no more valuable than mere true belief, even though knowledge is not identical with true belief. But, as we’ve seen, there is a widespread and resilient intuition that knowledge is more valuable than mere true belief (recall, for instance, that we tend to think that Yolanda’s epistemic state is better than Steve’s). If knowledge were identical with true belief, then we would have to take that intuition to be mistaken; but, since we can see that knowledge is more than mere true belief, we can continue looking for an acceptable account which would explain why knowledge is more valuable than mere true belief.

ii. Stability

Most attempts to explain why knowledge is more valuable than mere true belief proceed by identifying some condition which must be added to true belief in order to yield knowledge, and then explaining why that further condition is valuable. Socrates’s own view, at least as presented in the Meno, is that knowledge is true opinion plus an account of why the opinion is true (where the account of why it is true is itself already present in the soul, and it must only be recalled from memory). So, Socrates proposes, a known true belief will be more stable than a mere true belief, because having an account of why a belief is true helps to keep us from losing it. If you don’t have an account of why a proposition is true, you might easily forget it, or abandon your belief in it when you come across some reason for doubting it. But if you do have an account of why a proposition is true, you likely have a greater chance of remembering it, and if you come across some reason for doubting it, you’ll have a reason available to you for continuing to believe it.

A worry for this solution is that it seems to be entirely possible for a subject S to have some entirely unsupported beliefs, which do not count as knowledge, but where S clings to these beliefs dogmatically, even in the face of good counterevidence. S’s belief in a case like this can be just as stable as many items of knowledge – indeed, dogmatically held beliefs can even be more stable than knowledge. For if you know that p, then presumably your belief is a response to some sort of good reason for believing that p. But if your belief is a response to good reasons, then you’d likely be inclined to revise your belief that p, if you were to come across some good evidence for thinking that p is false, or for thinking that you didn’t have any good reason for believing that p in the first place. On the other hand, if p is something you cling to dogmatically (contrary evidence be damned), then you’ll likely retain p even when you get good reason for doubting it. So, even though having stable true beliefs is no doubt a good thing, knowledge isn’t always more stable than mere true belief, and an appeal to stability does not seem to give us an adequate explanation of the extra value of knowledge over mere true belief.

One way to defend the stability response to the value problem is to hold that knowledge is more stable than mere true beliefs, but only for people whose cognitive faculties are in good working order, and to deny that the cognitive faculties of people who cling dogmatically to evidentially unsupported beliefs are in good working order (Williamson 2000). This solution invites the objection, however, that our cognitive faculties are not all geared to the production of true beliefs. Some cognitive faculties are geared towards ensuring our survival, and the outputs of these latter faculties might be held very firmly even if they are not well supported by evidence. For example, there could be subjects with cognitive mechanisms which take as input sudden sounds and generate as output the belief that there’s a predator nearby. Mechanisms like these might very well generate a strong conviction that there’s a predator nearby. Such mechanisms would likely yield many more false positive predator-identifications than they would yield correct identifications, but their poor true-to-false output-ratio doesn’t prevent mechanisms of this kind from having a very high survival value, as long as they do correctly identify predators when they are present. So it’s not really clear that knowledge is more stable than mere true beliefs, even for mere true beliefs which have been produced by cognitive systems which are in good working order, because it’s possible for beliefs to be evidentially unsupported, and very stable, and produced by properly functioning cognitive faculties, all at the same time. (See Kvanvig 2003, ch1. for a critical discussion of Williamson’s appeal to stability.)

iii. Virtues

Virtue epistemologists are, roughly, those who think that knowledge is true belief which is the product of intellectual virtues. (See the article on Virtue Epistemology.) Virtue Epistemology seems to provide a plausible solution to the Primary (and, as we’ll see, to the Secondary) Value Problem.

According to a prominent strand of virtue epistemology, knowledge is true belief for which we give the subject credit (Greco 2003), or true belief which is a cognitive success because of the subject’s exercise of her relevant cognitive ability (Greco 2008; Sosa 2007). For example (to adapt Sosa’s analogy): an archer, in firing at a target, might shoot well or poorly. If she shoots poorly but hits the target anyway (say, she takes aim very poorly but sneezes at the moment of firing, and luckily happens to hit the target), her shot doesn’t display skill, and her hitting the target doesn’t reflect well on her. If she shoots well, on the other hand, then she might hit the target or miss the target. If she shoots well and misses the target, we will still credit her with having made a good shot, because her shot manifests skill. If she shoots well and hits the target, then we will credit her success to her having made a good shot – unless there were intervening factors which made it the case that the shot hit the mark just as a matter of luck. For example: if a trickster moves the target while the arrow is in mid-flight, but a sudden gust of wind moves the arrow to the target’s new location, then in spite of the fact that the archer makes a good shot, and she hits the target, she doesn’t hit the target because she made a good shot. She was just lucky, even though she was skillful. But when strange factors don’t intervene, and the archer hits the target because she made a good shot, we give her credit for having hit the target, since we think that performances which succeed because they are competent are the best kind of performances. And, similarly, when it comes to belief-formation, we give people credit for getting things right as a result of the exercise of their intellectual virtues: we think it’s an achievement to get things right as the result of one’s cognitive competence, and so we tend to think that there’s a sense in which people who get things right because of their intellectual competence deserve credit for getting things right.

According to another strand of virtue epistemology (Zagzebski 2003), we don’t think of knowledge as true belief which meets some further condition. Rather, we should think of knowledge as a state which a subject can be in, which involves having the propositional attitude of belief, but which also includes the motivations for which the subject has the belief. Virtuous motivations might include things like diligence, integrity, and a love of truth. And, just as we think that, in ethics, virtuous motives make actions better (saving a drowning child because you don’t want children to suffer and die is better than saving a drowning child because you don’t want to have to give testimony to the police, for example), we should also think that the state of believing because of a virtuous motive is better than believing for some other reason.

Some concerns have been raised for both strands of virtue epistemology, however. Briefly, a worry for the Sosa/Greco type of virtue epistemology is that (as we’ll see in section 3) knowledge might not after all in general be an achievement – it might be something we can come by in a relatively easy or even lazy fashion. A worry for Zagzebski’s type of virtue epistemology is that there seem to be possible cases where subjects can acquire knowledge even though they lack virtuous intellectual motives. Indeed, it seems possible to acquire knowledge even if one has only the darkest of motives: if a torturer is motivated by the desire to waterboard people until they go insane, for example, he can thereby gain knowledge of how long it takes to break a person by waterboarding.

iv. Reliabilism

The Primary Value Problem is sometimes thought to be especially bad for reliabilists about knowledge. Reliabilism in its simplest form is the view that beliefs are justified if and only if they’re produced by reliable processes, and they count as knowledge if and only if they’re true, and produced by reliable processes, and they’re not Gettiered. (See, for example, Goldman and Olsson (2009, p. 22), as well as the article on Reliabilism.) The apparent trouble for reliabilism is that reliability only seems to be valuable as a means to truth – so, in any given case where we have a true belief, it’s not clear that the reliability of the process which produced the belief is able to add anything to the value that the belief already has in virtue of being true. The value which true beliefs have in virtue of being true completely “swamps” the value of the reliability of their source, if reliability is only valuable as a means to truth. (Hence the Primary Value Problem for reliabilism has often been called the “swamping problem.”)

To illustrate (Zagzebski 2003): the value of a cup of coffee seems to be a matter of how good the coffee tastes. And we value reliable coffeemakers because we value good cups of coffee. But when it comes to the value of any particular cup of coffee, its value is just a matter of how good it tastes; whether the coffee was produced by a reliable coffeemaker doesn’t add to or detract from the value of the cup of coffee. Similarly, we value true beliefs, and we value reliable belief-forming processes because we care about getting true beliefs. So we have reason to prefer reliable processes over unreliable ones. But whether a particular belief was reliably or unreliably produced doesn’t seem to add to or detract from the value of the belief itself.

Responses have been offered on behalf of reliabilism. Brogaard (2006) points out that critics of reliabilism seem to have been presupposing a Moorean conception of value, according to which the value of an object (or state, condition, and so forth) is entirely a function of the internal properties of the object. (The value of the cup of coffee is determined entirely by its internal properties, not by the reliability of its production, or by the fineness of a particular morning when you enjoy your coffee.) But this seems to be a mistaken view about value in general. External features can add value to objects. We value a genuine Picasso painting more than a flawless counterfeit, for example. If that’s correct, then extra value can be conferred on an object, if it has a valuable source, and perhaps the value of reliable processes can transfer to the beliefs which they produce. Goldman and Olsson (2009) offer two further responses on behalf of reliabilism. Their first response is that we can hold that true belief is always valuable, and that reliability is only valuable as a means to true belief, but that it is still more valuable to have knowledge (understood as reliabilists understand knowledge, that is, as reliably-produced and unGettiered true belief) than a mere true belief. For if S knows that p in circumstances C, then S has formed the belief that p through some reliable process in C. So S has some reliable process available to her, and it generated a belief in C. This makes it more likely that S will have a reliable process available to her in future similar circumstances, than it would be if S had an unreliably produced true belief in C. So, when we’re thinking about how valuable it is to be in circumstances C, it seems to be better for S to be in C if S has knowledge in C than if she has mere true belief in C, because having knowledge in C makes it likelier that she’ll get more true beliefs in future similar circumstances.

This response, Goldman and Olsson think, accounts for the extra value which knowledge has in many cases. But there will still be cases where S’s having knowledge in C doesn’t make it likelier that she’ll get more true beliefs in the future. For example, C might be a unique set of circumstances which is unlikely to come up again. Or S might be employing a reliable process which is available to her in C, but which is likely to become unavailable to her very soon. Or S might be on her deathbed. So this response isn’t a completely validating solution to the value problem, and it’s incumbent on Goldman and Olsson to explain why we should tend to think that knowledge is more valuable than mere true belief in those cases when it’s not.

So Goldman and Olsson offer a second response to the Primary Value Problem: when it comes to our intuitions about the value of knowledge, they argue, it’s plausible that these intuitions began long ago with the recognition that true belief is always valuable in some sense to have, and that knowledge is usually valuable because it involves both true belief and the probability of getting more true beliefs; and then, over time, we have come to simply think that knowledge is valuable, even in cases when having knowledge doesn’t make it more probable that the subject will get more true beliefs in the future. (For some critical discussions and defenses of Goldan and Olsson’s treatment of the value problem, see Horvath (2009); Kvanvig (2010); and Olsson (2009; 2011)).

v. Contingent Features of Knowledge

An approach similar to Goldman and Olsson’s is to consider the values of contingent features of knowledge, rather than the value of its necessary and/or sufficient conditions. Although we might think that the natural way to account for the value of some state or condition S1, which is composed of other states or conditions S2-Sn, is in terms of the values of S2-Sn, perhaps S1 can be valuable in virtue of some other conditions which typically (but not always) accompany S1, or in terms of some valuable result which S1 is typically (but not always) able to get us. For example: it’s normal to think that air travel is valuable, because it typically enables people to cover great distances safely and quickly. Sometimes airplanes are diverted, and slow travellers down, and sometimes airplanes crash. But even so, we might continue to think, air travel is typically a valuable thing, because in ordinary cases, it gets us something good.

Similarly, we might think that knowledge is valuable because we need to rely on the information which people give us in order to accomplish just about anything in this life, and being able to identify people as having knowledge means being able to rely on them as informants. And we also might think that there’s value in being able to track whether our own beliefs are held on the basis of good reasons, and we typically have good reasons available to us for believing p when we know that p. We are not always in a position to identify when other people have knowledge, and if externalists about knowledge are right, then we don’t always have good reasons available to us when we have knowledge ourselves. Nevertheless, we can typically identify people as knowers, and we can typically identify good reasons for the things we know. These things are valuable, so they make typical cases of knowledge valuable, too. (See Craig (1990) for an account of the value of knowledge in terms of the characteristic function of knowledge-attribution. Jones (1997) further develops the view.)

Like Goldman and Olsson’s responses, this strategy for responding to the value problem doesn’t give us an account of why knowledge is always more valuable than mere true belief. For those who think that knowledge is always preferable to mere true belief, and who therefore seek a validating solution to the Primary Value Problem, this strategy will not be satisfactory. But for those who are willing to accept a somewhat revisionist response, according to which knowledge is only usually or characteristically preferable to mere true belief, this strategy seems promising.

vi. Derivative Non-Instrumental Value

Sylvan (2018) proposes the following principle as a way to explain the extra value that justification adds to true belief:

(The Extended Hurka Principle) When V is a non-instrumental value from the point of view of domain D, fitting ways of valuing V in D and their manifestations have some derivative non-instrumental value in D.

For instance, in the aesthetic domain, beauty is fundamentally valuable; but it’s also derivatively good to value or respect beauty, and it’s bad to disvalue or disrespect beauty. In the moral domain, beneficence is good; and it’s derivatively good to value or respect beneficence, and it’s bad to value or respect maleficence. And in the epistemic domain, true belief is good; but it’s also derivatively good to value or respect truth (by having justified beliefs), and it’s bad to disvalue or disrespect truth (by having unjustified beliefs).

In these domains, the derivatively valuable properties are not valuable because they promote or generate more of what is fundamentally valuable; rather, they are valuable because it’s just a good thing to manifest respect for what is fundamentally valuable. Still, Sylvan argues that the value of justification in the epistemic domain depends on and derives from the epistemic value of truth, because if truth were not epistemically valuable, then neither would respecting the truth be epistemically valuable.

A possible worry for this approach is that although respecting a fundamentally valuable thing might be good, it’s not clear that it adds domain-relative value to the thing itself (Bondy 2022). For instance, an artist passionately manifesting her love of beauty as she creates a sculpture does not necessarily make the sculpture itself better. The same might go for belief: perhaps the fact that a believer manifests respect for the truth in holding a belief does not necessarily make the belief itself any better.

b. The Secondary Value Problem

Suppose you’ve applied for a new position in your company, but your boss tells you that your co-worker Jones is going to get the job. Frustrated, you glance over at Jones, and see that he has ten coins on his desk, and you then watch him put the coins in his pocket. So you form the belief that the person who will get the job has at least ten coins in his or her pocket (call this belief “B”). But it turns out that your boss was just toying with you; he just wanted to see how you would react to bad news. He’s going to give you the job. And it turns out that you also have at least ten coins in your pocket.

So, you have a justified true belief, B, which has been Gettiered. In cases like this, once you’ve found out that you were Gettiered, it’s natural to react with annoyance or intellectual embarrassment: even though you got things right (about the coins, though not about who would get the job), and even though you had good reason to think you had things right, you were just lucky in getting things right.

If this is correct – if we do tend to prefer to have knowledge over Gettiered justified true beliefs – then this suggests that there’s a second value problem to be addressed. We seem to prefer having knowledge over having any proper subset of the parts of knowledge. But why should that be the case? What value is added to justified true beliefs, when they meet a suitable anti-Gettier condition?

i. No Extra Value

An initial response is to deny that knowledge is more valuable than mere justified true belief. If we’ve got true beliefs, and good reasons for them, we might be Gettiered, if for some reason it turns out that we’re just lucky in having true beliefs. When we inquire into whether p, we want to get to the truth regarding p, and we want to do so in a rationally defensible way. If it turns out that we get to the truth in a rationally defensible way, but strange factors of the case undermine our claim to knowing the truth about p, perhaps it just doesn’t matter that we don’t have knowledge.

Few epistemologists have defended this view, however (though Kaplan (1985) is an exception). We do after all find it irritating when we find out that we’ve been Gettiered; and when we are considering corresponding cases of knowledge and of Gettiered justified true belief, we tend to think that the subject who has knowledge is better off than the subject who is Gettiered. We might be mistaken; there might be nothing better in knowledge than in mere justified true belief. But the presumption seems to be that knowledge is more valuable, and we should try to explain why that is so. Skepticism about the extra value of knowledge over mere justified true belief might be acceptable if we fail to find an adequate explanation, but we shouldn’t accept skepticism before searching for a good explanation.

ii. Virtues

We saw above that some virtue epistemologists think of knowledge in terms of the achievement of true beliefs as a result of the exercise of cognitive skills or virtues. And we do generally seem to value success that results from our efforts and skills (that is, we value success that’s been achieved rather than stumbled into (for example Sosa (2003; 2007) and Pritchard (2009)). So, because we have a cognitive aim of getting to the truth, and we can achieve that aim either as a result of luck or as a result of our skillful cognitive performance, it seems that the value of achieving our aims as a result of a skillful performance can help explain why knowledge is more valuable than mere true belief.

That line of thought works just as well as a response to the Secondary Value Problem as to the Primary Value Problem. For in a Gettier case, the subject has a justified true belief, but it’s just as a result of luck that she arrived at a true belief rather than a false one. By contrast, when a subject arrives at a true belief because she has exercised a cognitive virtue, it’s plausible to think that it’s not just lucky that she’s arrived at a true belief; she gets credit for succeeding in the aim of getting to the truth as a result of her skillful performance. So cases of knowledge do, but Gettier cases do not, exemplify the value of succeeding in achieving our aims as a result of a skillful performance.

iii. Knowledge and Factive Mental States

”Knowledge-first epistemology” (beginning with Williamson 2000) is the approach to epistemology that does not attempt to analyze knowledge in terms of other more basic concepts; rather, it takes knowledge to be fundamental, and it analyzes other concepts in terms of knowledge. Knowledge-first epistemologists still want to say informative things about what knowledge is, but they don’t accept the traditional idea that knowledge can be analyzed in terms of informative necessary and sufficient conditions.

Williamson argues that knowledge is the most general factive mental state. At least some mental states have propositional contents (the belief that p has the content p; the desire that p has the content p; and so on). Factive mental states are mental states which you can only be in when their contents are true. Belief isn’t a factive mental state, because you can believe p even if p is false. By contrast, knowledge is a factive mental state, because you can only know that p if p is true. Other factive mental states include seeing that (for example you can only see that the sun is up, if the sun really is up) and remembering that. Knowledge is the most general factive mental state, for Williamson, because any time you are in a factive mental state with the content that p, you must know that p. If you see that it’s raining outside, then you know that it’s raining outside. Otherwise – say, if you have a mere true belief that it’s raining, or if your true belief that it’s raining is justified but Gettiered – you only seem to see that it’s raining outside.

If Williamson is right, and knowledge really is the most general factive mental state, then it is easy enough to explain the value of knowledge over mere justified true belief. We care, for one thing, about having true beliefs, and we dislike being duped. We would especially dislike it if we found out that we were victims of widespread deception. (Imagine your outrage and intellectual embarrassment, for example, if you were to discover that you were living in your own version of The Truman Show!) But not only that: we also care about being in the mental states we think we’re in (we care about really remembering what we think we remember, for example), and we would certainly dislike being duped about our own mental states, including when we take ourselves to be in factive mental states. So if having a justified true belief that p which is Gettiered prevents us from being in the factive mental states we think we’re in, but having knowledge enables us to be in these factive mental states, then it seems that we should care about having knowledge.

iv. Internalism and the Basing Relation

Finally, internalists about knowledge have an interesting response to offer to the Secondary Value Problem. Internalism about knowledge is the view that a necessary condition on S’s knowing that p is that S must have good reasons available for believing that p (where this is usually taken to mean that S must be able to become aware of those reasons, just by reflecting on what reasons she has). Internalists will normally hold that you have to have good reasons available to you, and you have to hold your belief on the basis of those reasons, in order to have knowledge.

Brogaard (2006) argues that the fact that beliefs must be held on the basis of good reasons gives the internalist her answer to the Secondary Value Problem. Roughly, the idea is that, if you hold the belief that p on the basis of a reason q, then you must believe (at least dispositionally) that in your current circumstances, q is a reliable indicator of p’s truth. So you have a first-order belief, p, and you have a reason for believing p, which is q, and you have a second-order belief, r, to the effect that q is a reliable indicator of p’s truth. And when your belief that p counts as knowledge, your reason q must in fact be a reliable indicator of p’s truth in your current circumstances – which means that your second-order belief r is true. So, assuming that the extra-belief requirement for basing beliefs on reasons is correct, it follows that when you have knowledge, you also have a correct picture of how things stand more broadly speaking.

When you are in a Gettier situation, by contrast, there is some feature of the situation which makes it the case that your belief that q is not a reliable indicator of the truth of p. That means that your second-order belief r is false. So, even though you’ve got a true first-order belief, you have an incorrect picture of how things stand more broadly speaking. Assuming that it’s better to have a correct picture of how things stand, including a correct picture of what reasons are reliable indicators of the truth of our beliefs, knowledge understood in an internalist sense is more valuable than Gettiered justified true belief.

c. The Tertiary Value Problem

Pritchard (2007; 2010) suggests that there’s a third value problem to address (cf. also Zagzebski 2003). We often think of knowledge as distinctively valuable – that it’s a valuable kind of thing to have, and that its value isn’t the same kind of value as (for example) the value of true belief. If that’s correct, then simply identifying a kind of value which true beliefs have, and showing that knowledge has that same kind of value but to a greater degree, does not yield a satisfactory solution to this value problem.

By analogy, think of two distinct kinds of value: moral and financial. Suppose that both murders and mediocre investments are typically financially disvaluable, and suppose that murders are typically more financially disvaluable than mediocre investments. Even if we understand the greater financial disvalue of murders over the financial disvalue of mediocre investments, if we do not also understand that murders are disvaluable in a distinctively moral sense, then we will fail to grasp something fundamental about the disvalue of murder.

If knowledge is valuable in a way that is distinct from the way that true beliefs are valuable, then the kind of solution to the Primary Value Problem offered by Goldman and Olsson which we saw above isn’t satisfactory, because the extra value they identify is just the extra value of having more true beliefs. By contrast, as Pritchard suggests, if knowledge represents a cognitive achievement, in the way that virtue theorists often suggest, then because we do seem to think of achievements as being valuable just insofar as they are achievements (we value the overcoming of obstacles, and we value success which is attributable to a subject’s exercise of her skills or abilities), it follows that thinking of knowledge as an achievement provides a way to solve the Tertiary Value Problem. (Though, as we’ll see in section 3, Pritchard doesn’t think that knowledge in general represents an achievement.)

However, it’s not entirely clear that the Tertiary Value Problem is a real problem which needs to be addressed. (Haddock (2010) explicitly denies it, and Carter, Jarvis, and Rubin (2013) also register a certain skepticism before going on to argue that if there is a Tertiary Value Problem, it’s easy to solve.) Certainly most epistemologists who have attempted to solve the value problem have not worried about whether the extra value they were identifying in knowledge was different in kind from the value of mere true belief, or of mere justified true belief. Perhaps it is fair to say that it would be an interesting result if knowledge turned out to have a distinctive kind of value; maybe that would even be a mark in favour of an epistemological theory which had that result. But the consensus seems to be that, if we can identify extra value in knowledge, then that is enough to solve the value problem, even if the extra value is just a greater degree of the same kind of value which we find in the proper parts of knowledge such as true belief.

3. Truth and other Epistemic Values

We have been considering ways to try to explain why knowledge is more valuable than its proper parts. More generally, though, we might wonder what sorts of things are epistemically valuable, and just what makes something an epistemic value in the first place.

A natural way to proceed is simply to identify some state which epistemologists have traditionally been interested in, or which seems like it could or should be important for a flourishing cognitive life – such as the states of having knowledge, true belief, justification, wisdom, empirically adequate theories, and so on – and try to give some reason for thinking that it’s valuable to be in such a state.

Epistemologists who work on epistemic value usually want to explain either why true beliefs are valuable, or why knowledge is valuable, or both. Some also seek to explain the value of other states, such as understanding, and some seek to show that true beliefs and knowledge are not always as valuable as we might think.

Sustained arguments for the value of knowledge are easy to come by; the foregoing discussion of the Value Problem was a short survey of such arguments. Sustained arguments for the value of true belief, on the other hand, are not quite so plentiful. But it is especially important that we be able to show that true belief is valuable, if we are going to allow true belief to play a central role in epistemological theories. It is, after all, very easy to come up with apparently trivial true propositions, which no one is or ever will be interested in. Truths about how many grains of sand there are on some random beach, for example, seem to be entirely uninteresting. Piller suggests that “the string of letters we get, when we combine the third letters of the first ten passenger’s family names who fly on FR2462 to Bydgoszcz no more than seventeen weeks after their birthday with untied shoe laces” is an uninteresting truth, which no one would care about (2009, p.415). (Though see Treanor (2014) for an objection to arguments that proceed by comparing what appear to be more and less interesting truths.)  What is perhaps even worse, it is easy to construct cases where having a true belief is positively disvaluable. For example, if someone tells you how a movie will end before you see it, you will probably not enjoy the movie very much when you do get around to seeing it (Kelly 2003). Now, maybe these apparently trivial or disvaluable truths are after all at least a little bit valuable, in an epistemic sense – but on the face of them, these truths don’t seem valuable, so the claim that they are valuable needs to be argued for. We’ll see some such arguments shortly.

Keep in mind that although epistemologists often talk about the value of having true beliefs, this is usually taken to be short for the value of having true beliefs and avoiding false beliefs (though see Pritchard 2014 and Hutchinson 2021, who think that truth itself is what is valuable). These two aspects of what is usually referred to as a truth-goal are clearly related, but they are distinct, and sometimes they can pull in opposite directions. An extreme desire to avoid false beliefs can lead us to adopt some form of skepticism, for example, where we abandon all or nearly all of our beliefs, if we’re not careful. But in giving up all of our beliefs, we do not only avoid having false beliefs; we also lose all of the true beliefs we would have had. When the goals of truth-achievement and error-avoidance pull in opposite directions, we need to weigh the importance of getting true beliefs against the importance of avoiding false ones, and decide how much epistemic risk we’re willing to take on in our body of beliefs (cf. James 1949, Riggs 2003).

Still, because the twin goals of achieving true beliefs and avoiding errors are so closely related, and because they are so often counted as a single truth-goal, we can continue to refer to them collectively as a truth-goal. We just need to be careful to keep the twin aspects of the goal in mind.

a. Truth Gets Us What We Want

One argument for thinking that true beliefs are valuable is that without true beliefs, we cannot succeed in any of our projects. Since even the most unambitious of us care about succeeding in a great many things (even making breakfast is a kind of success, which requires a great many true beliefs), we should all think that it’s important to have true beliefs, at least when it comes to subjects that we care about.

An objection to this argument for the value of true beliefs is that, as we’ve already seen, there are many true propositions which seem not to be worth caring about, and some which can be positively harmful. So although true beliefs are good when they can get us things we want, that is not always the case. So this argument doesn’t establish that we should always care about the truth.

A response to this worry is that we will all be faced with new situations in the future, and we will need to have a broad range of true beliefs, and as few false beliefs mixed in with the true ones as we can, in order to have a greater chance of succeeding when such situations come up (Foley 1993, ch.1). So it’s a good idea to try to get as many true beliefs as we can. This line of argument gives us a reason to think that it’s always at least pro tanto valuable to have true beliefs (that is, there’s always something positive to be said for true beliefs, even if that pro tanto value can sometimes be overridden by other considerations).

This is a naturalistically acceptable kind of value for true beliefs to enjoy. Although it doesn’t ground the value of true beliefs in the fact that people always desire to have true beliefs, it does ground their value in their instrumental usefulness for getting us other things which we do in fact desire. The main drawback for this approach, however, is that when someone positively desires not to have a given true belief – say, because it will cause him pain, or prevent him from having an enjoyable experience at the movies – it doesn’t seem like his desires can make it at all valuable for him to have the true belief in question. The idea here was to try to ground the value of truths in their instrumental usefulness, in the way that they are good for getting us what we want. But if there are true beliefs which we know will not be useful in that way (indeed, if there are true beliefs which we know will be harmful to us), then those beliefs don’t seem to have anything to be said in favour of them – which is to say that they aren’t even pro tanto valuable.

Whether we think that this is a serious problem will depend on whether we think that the claim that true beliefs are valuable entails that true beliefs must always have at least pro tanto value. Sometimes epistemologists (for example White 2007) explicitly claim that true beliefs are not always valuable in any real sense, since we just don’t always care about having them; but, just as money is valuable even though it isn’t something that we always care about having, so too, true beliefs are still valuable, in a hypothetical sense: when we do want to have true beliefs, or when true beliefs are necessary for getting us what we want, they are valuable. So we can always say that they have value; it’s just that the kind of value in question is only hypothetical in nature. (One might worry, however, that “hypothetical” seems to be only a fancy way to say “not real.”)

b. What People Ought to Care About

A similar way to motivate the claim that true beliefs are valuable is to say that there are some things that we morally ought to care about, and we need to have true beliefs in order to achieve those things (Zagzebski 2003; 2009). For example, I ought to care about whether my choices as a consumer contribute to painful and degrading living and working conditions for people who produce what I am consuming. (I do care about that, but even if I did not, surely, I ought to care about it.) But in order to buy responsibly, and avoid supporting corporations that abuse their workers, I need to have true beliefs about the practices of various corporations.

So, since there are things we should care about, and since we need true beliefs to successfully deal with things which we should care about, it follows that we should care about having true beliefs.

This line of argument is unavailable to anyone who wants to avoid positing the existence of objective values which exist independently of what people actually desire or care about, and it doesn’t generate any value for true beliefs which aren’t relevant to things we ought to care about. But if there are things which we ought to care about, then it seems correct to say that at least in many cases, true beliefs are valuable, or worth caring about.

Lynch (2004) gives a related argument for the objective value of truth. Although he doesn’t ground the value of true beliefs in things that we morally ought to care about, his central argument is that it’s important to care about the truth for its own sake, because caring for the truth for its own sake is part of what it is to have intellectual integrity, and intellectual integrity is an essential part of a healthy, flourishing life. (He also argues that a concern for the truth for its own sake is essential for a healthy democracy.)

c. Proper Functions

Some epistemologists (for example Plantinga 1993; Bergmann 2006; Graham 2011) invoke the proper functions of our cognitive systems in order to argue for (or to explain) the value of truth, and to explain the connection between truth and justification or warrant. Proper functions are usually given a selected-effects gloss, following Millikan (1984). The basic idea is that an organ or a trait (T), which produces an effect (E), has the production of effects of type E as its proper function just in case the ancestors of T also produced effects of type E, and the fact that they produced effects of type E is part of a correct explanation of why the Ts (or the organisms which have Ts) survived and exist today. For example, hearts have the proper function of pumping blood because hearts were selected for their ability to pump blood – the fact that our ancestors had hearts that pumped blood is part of a correct explanation of why they survived, reproduced, and why we exist today and have hearts that pump blood.

Similarly, the idea goes, we have cognitive systems which have been selected for producing true beliefs. And if that’s right, then our cognitive systems have the proper function of producing true beliefs, which seems to mean that there is always at least some value in having true beliefs.

It’s not clear whether selected-effect functions are in fact normative, however (in the sense of being able by themselves to generate reasons or value). Millikan, at least, thought that proper functions are normative. Others have disagreed (for example Godfrey-Smith 1998). Whether we can accept this line of argument for the value of true beliefs will depend on whether we think that selected-effects functions are capable of generating value by themselves, or whether they only generate value when taken in a broader context which includes reference to the desires and the wellbeing of agents.

A further potential worry with the proper-function explanation of the value of true beliefs is that there seem to be cognitive mechanisms which have been selected for, and which systematically produce, false beliefs. (See Hazlett (2013), for example, who considers cognitive biases such as the self-enhancement bias at considerable length.) Plantinga (1993) suggests that we should distinguish truth-directed cognitive mechanisms from others, and say that it’s only the proper functioning of well-designed, truth-conducive mechanisms that yield warranted beliefs. But if this response works, it’s only because there’s some way to explain why truth is valuable, other than saying that our cognitive mechanisms have been selected for producing true beliefs; otherwise there would be no reason to suggest that it’s only the truth-directed mechanisms that are relevant to warranted and epistemically valuable beliefs.

d. Assuming an Epistemic Value/Critical Domains of Evaluation

Many epistemologists don’t think that we need to argue that truth is a valuable thing to have (for example BonJour 1985, Alston 1985; 2005, Sosa 2007). All we need to do is to assume that there is a standpoint which we take when we are doing epistemology, or when we’re thinking about our cognitive lives, and stipulate that the goal of achieving true beliefs and avoiding errors is definitive of that standpoint. We can simply assume that truth is a real and fundamental epistemic value, and proceed from there.

Proponents of this approach still sometimes argue for the claim that achieving the truth and avoiding error is the fundamental epistemic value. But when they do, their strategy is to assume that there must be some distinctively epistemic value which is fundamental (that is, which orients our theories of justification and knowledge, and which explains why we value other things from an epistemic standpoint), and then to argue that achieving true beliefs does a better job as a fundamental epistemic value than other candidate values do.

The strategy here isn’t to argue that true beliefs are always valuable, all things considered. The strategy is to argue only that true belief is of fundamental value insofar as we are concerned with evaluating beliefs (or belief-forming processes, practices, institutions, and so forth) from an epistemic point of view. True beliefs are indeed sometimes bad to have, all things considered (as when you know how a movie will end), and not everyone always cares about having true beliefs. But enough of us care about having true beliefs in a broad enough range of cases that a critical domain of evaluation has arisen, which takes true belief as its fundamental value.

In support of this picture of epistemology and epistemic value, Sosa (2007) compares epistemology to the critical domain of evaluation which centers on good coffee. That domain takes the production and consumption of good cups of coffee as its fundamental value, and it has a set of evaluative practices in light of that goal. Many people take that goal seriously, and we have enormous institutional structures in place which exist entirely for the purpose of achieving the goal of producing good cups of coffee. But there are people who detest coffee, and perhaps coffee isn’t really valuable at all. (Perhaps…) But even so, enough people take the goal of producing good coffee to be valuable that we have generated a critical domain of evaluation centering on the value of producing good coffee, and even people who don’t care about coffee can still recognize good coffee, and they can engage in the practices which go with taking good coffee as a fundamental value of a critical domain. And for Sosa, the value of true belief is to epistemology as the value of good cups of coffee is to the domain of coffee production and evaluation.

One might worry, however, that this sort of move cannot accommodate the apparently non-optional nature of epistemic evaluation. It’s possible to opt out of the practice of making evaluations of products and processes in terms of the way that they promote the goal of producing tasty cups of coffee, but our epistemic practices don’t seem to be optional in that way. Even if I were to foreswear any kind of commitment to the importance of having epistemically justified beliefs, for example, you could appropriately level criticism at me if my beliefs were to go out of sync with my evidence.

e. Anti-Realism

An important minority approach to epistemic value and epistemic normativity is a kind of anti-realism, or conventionalism. The idea is that there is no sense in which true beliefs are really valuable, nor is there a sense in which we ought to try to have true beliefs, except insofar as we (as individuals, or as a community) desire to have true beliefs, or we are willing to endorse the value of having true beliefs.

One reason for being anti-realist about epistemic value is that you might be dissatisfied with all of the available attempts to come up with a convincing argument for thinking that truth (or anything else) is something which we ought to value. Hazlett (2013) argues against the “eudaimonic ideal” of true belief, which is the idea that even though true beliefs can be bad for us in exceptional circumstances, still, as a rule, true beliefs systematically promote human flourishing better than false beliefs do. One of Hazlett’s main objections to this idea is that there are types of cases where true beliefs are systematically worse for us than false beliefs. For example, people who have an accurate sense of what other people think of them tend to be more depressed than people who have an inflated sense of what others think of them. When it comes to beliefs about what others think about us, then, true beliefs are systematically worse for our wellbeing than corresponding false beliefs would be.

Because Hazlett thinks that the problems facing a realist account of epistemic value and epistemic norms are too serious, he adopts a form of conventionalism, according to which epistemic norms are like club rules. Just as a club might adopt the rule that they will not eat peas with spoons, so too, we humans have adopted epistemic rules such as the rule that we should believe only what the evidence supports. The justification for this rule isn’t that it’s valuable in any real sense to believe what the evidence supports; rather, the justification is just that the rule of believing in accord with the evidence is in fact a rule that we have adopted. (A worry for this approach, however, is that epistemic rules seem to be non-optional in a way that club rules are not. Clubs can change their rules by taking a vote, for example, whereas it doesn’t seem as though epistemic agents can do any such thing.)

f. Why the Focus on Truth?

We’ve been looking at some of the main approaches to the question of whether and why true beliefs are epistemically valuable. For a wide range of epistemologists, true beliefs play a fundamental role in their theories, so it’s important to try to see why we should think that truth is valuable. But, given that we tend to value knowledge more than we value true belief, one might wonder why true belief is so often taken to be a fundamental value in the epistemic domain. Indeed, not only do many of us think that knowledge is more valuable than mere true belief; we also think that there are a number of other things which should also count as valuable from the epistemic point of view: understanding, justification, simplicity, empirical adequacy of theories, and many other things too, seem to be important kinds of cognitive successes. These seem like prime candidates for counting as epistemically valuable – so why do they so often play such a smaller role in epistemological theories than true belief plays?

There are three main reasons why truth is often invoked as a fundamental epistemic value, and why these other things are often relegated to secondary roles. The first reason is that, as we saw in section 2(a), true beliefs do at least often seem to enable us to accomplish our goals and achieve what we want. And they typically enable us to do so whether or not they count as knowledge, or even whether or not they’re justified, or whether they represent relatively simple hypotheses. This seems like a reason to care about having true beliefs, which doesn’t depend on taking any other epistemic states to be valuable.

The second reason is that, if we take true belief to be the fundamental epistemic value, we will still be able to explain why we should think of many other things aside from true beliefs as epistemically valuable. If justified beliefs tend to be true, for example, and having true beliefs is the fundamental epistemic value, then justification will surely also be valuable, as a means to getting true beliefs (this is suggested in a widely-cited and passage in (BonJour 1985, pp.7-8)). Similarly, we might be able to explain the epistemic value of simplicity in terms of the value of truth, because the relative simplicity of a hypothesis can be evidence that the hypothesis is more likely than other competing hypotheses to be true. On one common way of thinking about simplicity, a hypothesis H1 is simpler than another hypothesis H2 if H1 posits fewer theoretical entities. Understanding simplicity in that way, it’s plausible to think that simpler hypotheses are likelier to be true, because there are fewer ways for them to go wrong (there are fewer entities for them to be mistaken about).

By contrast, it is not so straightforward to try to explain the value of truth in terms of other candidate epistemic values, such as simplicity or knowledge. If knowledge were the fundamental (as opposed to the highest, or one of the highest) epistemic value, so that the value of true beliefs would have to be dependent on the value of knowledge, then it seems that it would be difficult to explain why unjustified true beliefs should be more valuable than unjustified false beliefs, which they seem to be.

And the third reason why other candidate epistemic values are not often invoked in setting out epistemic theories is that, even if there are epistemically valuable things which do not get all of their epistemic value from their connection with true belief, there is a particular theoretical role which many epistemologists want the central epistemic goal or value to play, and it can only play that role if it’s understood in terms of achieving true beliefs and avoiding false ones (David 2001; cf. Goldman 1979). Briefly, the role in question is that of providing a way to explain our epistemic notions, including especially the notions of knowledge and epistemic rationality, in non-epistemic terms. Since truth is not itself an epistemic term, it can play this role. But other things which seem to be epistemically valuable, like knowledge and rationality, cannot play this role, because they are themselves epistemic terms. We will come back to the relation between the analysis of epistemic rationality and the formulation of the epistemic goal in the final section of this article.

Still, “veritism,” or “truth-value-monism”—the view that truth, or true belief, is the sole or the fundamental epistemic value—has come in for heavy criticism in recent years. Pluralists argue that there are multiple states or properties that have independent epistemic value (for example, DePaul 2001; Kvanvig 2005; Brogaard 2009; Madison 2017); some argue that truth is not particularly valuable, or not particularly epistemically valuable (for example Feldman 2000; Wrenn 2017); and as we saw above, some epistemologists argue that knowledge is what is primarily valuable, and that the attempt to explain the value of knowledge in terms of the value of truth is misguided (for example, Littlejohn 2018; Aschliman 2020) For defenses of veritism from some of its challenges, see (Ahlstrom-Vij 2013; Pritchard 2014; 2021).

4. Understanding

There is growing support among epistemologists for the idea that understanding is the highest epistemic value, more valuable even than knowledge. There are various ways of fleshing out this view, depending on what kind of understanding we have in mind, and depending on whether we want to remain truth-monists about what’s fundamentally epistemically valuable or not.

a. Understanding: Propositions and Domains; Subjective and Objective

If you are a trained mechanic, then you understand how automobiles work. This is an understanding of a domain, or of a kind of object. To have an understanding of a domain, you need to have a significant body of beliefs about that domain, which fits together in a coherent way, and which involves beliefs about what would explain why things happen as they do in that domain. When you have such a body of beliefs, we can say that you have a subjective understanding of the domain (Grimm 2012). When, in addition, your beliefs about the domain are mostly correct, we can say that you have an objective understanding of the domain.

In addition to understanding a domain, you might also understand that p – you might understand that some proposition is true. There are several varieties of propositional understanding: there is simply understanding that p; there is understanding why p, which involves understanding that p because q; there is understanding when p, which involves understanding that p happens at time t, and understanding why p happens at time t; and so on, for other wh- terms, such as who and where. In what follows, we’ll talk in general in terms of propositional understanding, or understanding that p, to cover all these cases.

Understanding that p entails having at least some understanding of a domain. To borrow an example of Pritchard’s (2009): imagine that you come home to find your house burnt to the ground. You ask the fire chief what caused the fire, and he tells you that it was faulty wiring. Now you know why your house burnt to the ground (you know that it burnt down because of the faulty wiring), and you also understand why your house burnt to the ground (you know that the house burnt down because of faulty wiring, and you have some understanding of the kinds of things that tend to start fires, such as sparks, or overheating, both of which can be caused by faulty wiring.) You understand why the house burnt down, in other words, only because you have some understanding of how fires are caused.

As Kvanvig (2003) notes, it’s plausible that you only genuinely understand that p if you have a mostly correct (that is, an objective) understanding of the relevant domain. For suppose that you have a broad and coherent body of beliefs about celestial motion, but which centrally involves the belief that the earth is at the center of the universe. Because your body of beliefs involves mistaken elements at its core, we would normally say that you misunderstand celestial motions, and you misunderstand why (for example) we can observe the sun rising every day. In a case like this, where you misunderstand why p (for example why the sun comes up), we can say that you have a subjective propositional understanding: your belief that the sun comes up every day because the earth is at the center of the Universe, and the celestial bodies all rotate around it, can be coherent with a broader body of justified beliefs, and it can provide explanations of celestial motions. But because your understanding of the domain of celestial motion involves false beliefs at its core, you have an incorrect understanding of the domain, and your explanatory propositional understanding, as a result, is also a misunderstanding.

By contrast, when your body of beliefs about a domain is largely correct, and your understanding of the domain leads you to believe that p is true because q is true, we can say that you have an objective understanding of why p is true. In what follows, except where otherwise specified, “understanding” refers to objective propositional understanding.

b. The Location of the Special Value of Understanding

It seems natural to think that understanding that p involves knowing that p, plus something extra, where the extra bit is something like having a roughly correct understanding of some relevant domain to do with p: you understand that p when (and only when) you know that p, and your belief that p fits into a broader, coherent, explanatory body of beliefs, where this body of beliefs is largely correct. So the natural place to look for the special epistemic value of understanding is in the value of this broader body of beliefs.

Some authors (Kvanvig 2003; Hills 2009; Pritchard 2009) have argued that propositional understanding does not require the corresponding propositional knowledge: S can understand that p, they argue, even if S doesn’t know that p. The main reason for this view is that understanding seems to be compatible with a certain kind of luck, environmental luck, which is incompatible with knowledge. For example, think again of the case where you ask the fire chief the cause of the fire, but now imagine that there are many pretend fire chiefs all walking around the area in uniform, and it’s just a matter of luck that you asked the real fire chief. In this case, it seems fairly clear that you lack knowledge of the cause of the fire, since you could so easily have asked a fake fire chief, and formed a false belief as a result. But, the argument goes, you do gain understanding of the cause of the fire from the fire chief. After all, you have gained a true belief about what caused the fire, and your belief is justified, and it fits in with your broader understanding of the domain of fire-causing. What we have here is a case of a justified true belief, where that belief fits in with your understanding of the relevant domain, but where you have been Gettiered, so you lack knowledge.

So, it’s controversial whether understanding that p really presupposes knowing that p. But when it comes to the value of understanding, we can set this question aside. For even if there are cases of propositional understanding without the corresponding propositional knowledge, still, most cases of propositional understanding involve the corresponding propositional knowledge, and in those cases, the special value of understanding will lie in what is added to the propositional knowledge to yield understanding. In cases where there is Gettierizing environmental luck, so that S has a Gettierized justified true belief which fits in with her understanding of the relevant domain, the special value of understanding will lie in what is added to justified true belief. In other words, whether or not propositional understanding presupposes the corresponding propositional knowledge, the special value of propositional understanding will be located in the subject’s understanding of the relevant domain.

c. The Value of Understanding

There are a few plausible accounts of why understanding should be thought of as distinctively epistemically valuable, and perhaps even as the highest epistemic value. One suggestion, which would be friendly to truth-monists about epistemic value, is that we can consistently hold both that truth is the fundamental epistemic value and that understanding is the highest epistemic value. Because understanding that p typically involves both knowing that p and having a broader body of beliefs, where this body of beliefs is coherent and largely correct, it follows from the fundamental value of true beliefs that in any case where S understands that p, S’s cognitive state involves greater epistemic value than if S were merely to truly believe that p, because S has many other true beliefs too. On this picture, understanding doesn’t have a distinctive kind of value, but it does have a greater quantity of value than true belief, or even than knowledge. But, for a truth-monist about epistemic value, this is just the result that should be desired – otherwise, the view would no longer be monistic.

An alternative suggestion, which does not rely on truth-monism about epistemic value, is that the value of having a broad body of beliefs which provide an explanation for phenomena is to be explained by the fact that whether you have such a body of beliefs is transparent to you: you can always tell whether you have understanding (Zagzebski 2001). And surely, if it’s always transparent to you whether you understanding something, that is a source of extra epistemic value for understanding on top of the value of having true belief or even knowledge, since we can’t in general tell whether we are in those states.

The problem with this suggestion, though, as Grimm (2006; 2012) points out, is that we cannot always tell whether we have understanding. It often happens that we think we understand something, when in fact we gravely misunderstand it. It might be the case that we can always tell whether we have a subjective understanding – we might always be able to tell whether we have a coherent, explanatory body of beliefs – but we are not in general in a position to be able to tell whether our beliefs are largely correct. The subjective kind of understanding doesn’t entail the objective kind. Still, it is worth noting that there seems to be a kind of value in being aware of the coherence and explanatory power of one’s beliefs on a given topic, even if it’s never transparent whether one’s beliefs are largely correct. (See Kvanvig 2003 for more on the value of internal awareness and of having coherent bodies of beliefs.)

A third suggestion about the value of understanding, which is also not committed to truth-monism, is that having understanding can plausibly be thought of as a kind of success which is properly attributable to one’s exercise of a relevant ability, or in other words, an achievement. As we saw above, a number of virtue epistemologists think that we can explain the distinctive value of knowledge by reference to the fact that knowledge is a cognitive achievement. But others (notably, Lackey 2006 and 2009) have denied that subjects in general deserve credit for their true belief in cases of knowledge. Cases of testimonial knowledge are popular counterexamples to the view that knowledge is in general an achievement: when S learns some fact about local geography from a random bystander, for example, S can gain knowledge, but if anyone deserves credit for S’s true belief, it seems to be the bystander. So, if that’s right, then it’s not after all always much of an achievement to gain knowledge.

Pritchard (2009) also argues that knowledge is not in general an achievement, but he claims that understanding is. For when S gains an understanding that p, it seems that S must bring to bear significant cognitive resources, unlike when S only gains knowledge that p. Suppose, for example, that S asks bystander B where the nearest tourist information booth is, and B tells him. Now let’s compare S’s and B’s cognitive states. S has gained knowledge of how to get to the nearest information booth, but S doesn’t have an understanding of the location of the nearest information booth, since S lacks knowledge of the relevant domain (that is, local geography). B, on the other hand, both knows and understands the location of the nearest booth. And B’s understanding of the local geography, and her consequent understanding of the location of the nearest booth, involves an allocation of significant cognitive resources. (Anyone who has had to quickly memorize the local geography of a new city will appreciate how much cognitive work goes into having a satisfactory understanding of this kind of domain.)

d. Alternatives to the Natural Picture of the Value of Understanding

If understanding that p requires both knowing that p (or having a justified true belief that p) and having a broader body of beliefs which is coherent, explanatory, and largely correct, then it’s plausible to think that the special value of understanding is in the value of having such a body of beliefs. But it’s possible to resist this view of the value of understanding in a number of ways. One way to resist it would be to deny that understanding is ever any different from knowing. Reductivists about understanding think that it’s not possible to have knowledge without having understanding, or understanding without knowledge.  Sliwa (2015) argues, for example, that when S knows that p, S must understand that p at least to some extent. S has a better understanding that p when S has a better understanding of the relevant domain, in the form of knowledge of more related propositions, but S knows that p if and only if S has some understanding that p.

For reductivists about understanding, there can obviously be no value in understanding beyond the value of having knowledge. There are better and worse understandings, but any genuine (objective) understanding involves at least some knowledge, and better understanding just involves more knowledge. If that’s right, then we don’t need to say that understanding has more value than knowledge.

A second way to resist the approach to the value of understanding presented in the previous section is to resist the claim that understanding requires that one’s beliefs about a domain must be mostly correct. Elgin (2007; 2009), for example, points out that in the historical progression of science, there have been stages at which scientific understanding, while useful and epistemically good, centrally involved false beliefs about the relevant domains. Perhaps even more importantly, scientists regularly employ abstract or idealized models, which are known to be strictly false – but they use these models to gain a good understanding of the domain or phenomenon in question. And the resulting understanding is better, rather than worse, because of the use of these models, which are strictly speaking false. So the elimination of all falsehoods from our theories is not even desirable, on Elgin’s view. (In the language of subjective and objective understanding, we might say that Elgin thinks that subjective understanding can be every bit as good to have as objective understanding. We need to keep in mind, though, that Elgin would reject the view that subjective understandings which centrally involve false beliefs are necessarily misunderstandings.)

5. Instrumentalism and Epistemic Goals

The final topic we need to look at now is the relation between epistemic values and the concept of epistemic rationality or justification. According to one prominent way of analyzing epistemic rationality, the instrumental conception of epistemic rationality, beliefs are epistemically rational when and just to the extent that they appropriately promote the achievement of a distinctively epistemic goal. This approach can measure the epistemic rationality of individual beliefs by how well they themselves do with respect to the epistemic goal (for example, Foley 1987); or it can measure the rationality of whole belief-systems by how accurate they are, according to some appropriate formal rule that scores bodies of beliefs in light of the epistemic goal (for example, Joyce 1998).

The instrumental conception has been endorsed by many epistemologists over the past several decades (for example BonJour 1985; Alston 1985, 2005; Foley 1987, 1993, 2008), though a number of important criticisms of it have emerged in recent years (for example Kelly 2003; Littlejohn 2012; Hazlett 2013). For instrumentalists, getting the right accounts of epistemic goals and epistemic rationality are projects which constrain each other. Whether or not we want to accept instrumentalism in the end, it’s important to see the way that instrumentalists think of the relation of epistemic goals and epistemic rationality.

a. The Epistemic Goal as a Subset of the Epistemic Values

The first thing to note about the instrumentalist’s notion of an epistemic goal is that it has to do with what is valuable from an epistemic or cognitive point of view. But instrumentalists typically are not concerned to identify a set of goals which is exhaustive of what is epistemically valuable. Rather, they are concerned with identifying an epistemically valuable goal which is capable of generating a plausible, informative, and non-circular account of epistemic rationality in instrumental terms, and it’s clear that not all things that seem to be epistemically valuable can be included in an epistemic goal which is going to play that role. David (2001) points out that if we take knowledge or rationality (or, we might also add here, understanding) to be part of the epistemic goal, then the instrumental account of epistemic rationality becomes circular. This is most obvious with rationality: rationality is no doubt something we think is epistemically valuable, but if we include rationality in the formulation of the epistemic goal, and we analyze epistemic rationality in terms of achieving the epistemic goal, then we’ve analyzed epistemic rationality as the appropriate promotion of the goal of getting epistemically rational beliefs – an unhelpfully circular analysis, at best. And, if knowledge and understanding presuppose rationality, we also cannot include knowledge or understanding in the formulation of the epistemic goal.

This is one important reason why many epistemologists have taken the epistemic goal to be about achieving true beliefs and avoiding false ones. That seems to be a goal which is valuable from an epistemic point of view, and it stands a good chance at grounding a non-circular analysis of epistemic rationality.

David in fact goes a step further, and claims that because true belief is the only thing that is epistemically valuable that is capable of grounding an informative and non-circular analysis of epistemic rationality, truth is the only thing that’s really valuable from an epistemic point of view; knowledge, he thinks, is an extra-epistemic value. But it’s possible for pluralists about epistemic value to appreciate David’s point that only some things that are epistemically valuable (such as having true beliefs) are suitable for being taken up in the instrumentalist’s formulation of the epistemic goal. In other words, pluralism about epistemic values is consistent with monism about the epistemic goal.

b. Common Formulations of the Epistemic Goal

Now, there are two further important constraints on how to formulate the epistemic goal. First, it must be plausible to take as a goal – that is, as something we do in fact care about, or at least something that seems to be worth caring about even if people don’t in fact care about it. We might express this constraint by saying that the epistemic goal must be at least pro tanto valuable in either a subjective or an objective sense. And second, the goal should enable us to categorize clear cases of epistemically rational and irrational beliefs correctly. We can close this discussion of epistemic values and goals by considering three oft-invoked formulations of the epistemic goal, and noting the important differences between them. According to these formulations, the epistemic goal is:

(1) “to amass a large body of beliefs with a favorable truth-falsity ratio” (Alston 1985, p.59);

(2) “maximizing true beliefs and minimizing false beliefs about matters of interest and importance” (Alston 2005, p.32); and

(3) “now to believe those propositions that are true and now not to believe those propositions that are false” (Foley 1987, p.8).

Each of these formulations of the epistemic goal emphasizes the achievement of true beliefs and the avoidance of false ones. But there are two important dimensions along which they diverge.

c. Differences between the Goals: Interest and Importance

The first difference is with respect to whether the epistemic goal includes all propositions (or, perhaps, all propositions which a person could conceivably grasp), or whether it includes only propositions about matters of interest or importance. Formulation (2) includes an “interest and importance” clause, whereas (1) and (3) do not. The reason for including a reference to interest and importance is that it makes the epistemic goal much more plausible to take as a goal which is pro tanto valuable. For, as we have seen, there are countless examples of apparently utterly trivial or even harmful true propositions, which one might think are not worth caring about having. This seems like a reason to restrict the epistemic goal to having true beliefs and avoiding false ones about matters of interest and importance: we want to have true beliefs, but only when it is interesting or important to us to have them.

The drawback of an interest and importance clause in the epistemic goal is that it seems to prevent the instrumental approach from providing a fully general account of epistemic rationality. For it seems possible to have epistemically rational or irrational beliefs about utterly trivial or even harmful propositions. Suppose I were to come across excellent evidence about the number times the letter “y” appears in the seventeenth space on all lines in the first three and the last three sections of this article. Even though that strikes me as an utterly trivial truth, which I don’t care about believing, I might still come to believe what my evidence supports regarding it. And if I do, then it’s plausible to think that my belief will count as epistemically rational, because it’s based on good evidence. If it is not part of the epistemic goal that we should achieve true beliefs about even trivial or harmful matters, then it doesn’t seem like instrumentalists have the tools to account for our judgments of epistemic rationality or irrationality in such cases. This seems to give us a reason to make the epistemic goal include all true propositions, or at least all true propositions which people can conceivably grasp. (Such a view might be supported by appeal to the arguments for the general value of truth which we saw above, in section 2.)

d. Differences between the Goals: Synchronic and Diachronic Formulations

The second difference between the three formulations of the epistemic goal is regarding whether the goal is synchronic or diachronic. Formulation (3) is synchronic: it is about now having true beliefs and avoiding false ones. (Or, if we are considering a subject S’s beliefs at a time t other than the present, the goal is to believe true propositions and not believe false ones, at t.) Formulations (1) and (2) are neutral on that question.

A reason for accepting a diachronic formulation of the epistemic goal is that it is, after all, plausible to think that we do care about having true beliefs and avoiding false beliefs over the long run. Having true beliefs now is a fine thing, but having true beliefs now and still having them ten minutes from now is surely better. A second reason for adopting a diachronic formulation of the goal, offered by Vahid (2003), is to block Maitzen’s (1995) argument that instrumentalists who think that the epistemic goal is about having true beliefs cannot say that there are justified false beliefs, or unjustified true beliefs. Briefly, Maitzen argues that false beliefs can never, and true beliefs can never fail to, promote the achievement of the goal of getting true beliefs and avoiding false ones. Vahid replies that if the epistemic goal is about having true beliefs over the long run, then false beliefs can count as justified, in virtue of their truth-conducive causal histories.

The reason why instrumentalists like Foley formulate the epistemic goal instead in synchronic terms is to avoid the counterintuitive result that the epistemic status of a subject’s beliefs at t can depend on what happens after t. For example: imagine that you have very strong evidence at time t for thinking that you are a terrible student, but you are extremely confident in yourself anyway, and you hold the belief at t that you are a good student. At t+1, you consider whether to continue your studies or to drop out of school. Because of your belief about your abilities as a student, you decide to continue with your studies. And in continuing your studies, you go on to become a better student, and you learn all sorts of new things.

In this case, your belief at t that you are a good student does promote the achievement of a large body of beliefs with a favorable truth-falsity ratio over the long run. But by hypothesis, your belief is held contrary to very strong evidence at time t. The intuitive verdict in such cases seems to be that your belief at t that you are a good student is epistemically irrational. So, since the belief promotes the achievement of a diachronic epistemic goal, but not a synchronic one, we should make the epistemic goal synchronic. Or, if we want to maintain that the epistemic goal is diachronic, we can do so, as long as we are willing to accept the cost of adopting a partly revisionary view about what’s epistemically rational to believe in some cases where beliefs are held contrary to good available evidence.

6. Conclusion

We’ve gone through some of the central problems to do with epistemic value here. We’ve looked at attempts to explain why and in what sense knowledge is more valuable than any of its proper parts, and we’ve seen attempts to explain the special epistemic value of understanding. We’ve also looked at some attempts to argue for the fundamental epistemic value of true belief, and the role that the goal of achieving true beliefs and avoiding false ones plays when epistemologists give instrumentalist accounts of the nature of epistemic justification or rationality. Many of these are fundamental and important topics for epistemologists to address, both because they are intrinsically interesting, and also because of the implications that our accounts of knowledge and justification have for philosophy and inquiry more generally (for example, implications for norms of assertion, for norms of practical deliberation, and for our conception of ourselves as inquirers, to name just a few).

7. References and Further Reading

• Ahlstrom-Vij, Kristoffer (2013). In Defense of Veritistic Value Monism. Pacific Philosophical Quarterly. 94: 1, 19-40.
• Ahlstrom-Vij, Kristoffer, and Jeffrey Dunn (2018). Epistemic Consequentialism. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • This useful volume contains essays that develop, criticize, and defend consequentialist (instrumentalist) accounts of epistemic norms. Much of the volume concerns formal approaches to scoring beliefs and belief-systems in light of the epistemic goal of achieving true beliefs and avoiding false beliefs.
• Alston, William (1985). Concepts of Epistemic Justification. The Monist. 68. Reprinted in his Epistemic Justification: Essays in the Theory of Knowledge. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press, 1989.
  • Discusses concepts of epistemic justification. Espouses an instrumentalist account of epistemic evaluation.
• Alston, William (2005). Beyond Justification: Dimensions of Epistemic Evaluation. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press.
  • Abandons the concept of epistemic justification as too simplistic; embraces the pluralist idea that there are many valuable ways to evaluate beliefs. Continues to endorse the instrumentalist approach to epistemic evaluations.
• Aschliman, Lance (2020). Is True Belief Really a Fundamental Value? Episteme. 17: 1, 88-104.
• Bergmann, Michael (2006). Justification without Awareness. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Bondy, Patrick (2018). Epistemic Rationality and Epistemic Normativity. Routledge.
  • Considers three strategies for explaining the normativity of epistemic reasons; criticizes instrumentalism about the nature of epistemic reasons and rationality; defends instrumentalism about the normativity of epistemic reasons.
• Bondy, Patrick (2022). Avoiding Epistemology’s Swamping Problem: Instrumental Normativity without Instrumental Value. Southwest Philosophy Review.
  • Argues that the normativity of epistemic reasons is instrumental. Also raises worries for Sylvan’s (2018) derivative but non-instrumental approach to the epistemic value of justification and knowledge.
• BonJour, Laurence (1985). The Structure of Empirical Knowledge. Cambridge, Mass: Harvard University Press.
  • Develops a coherentist internalist account of justification and knowledge. Gives a widely-cited explanation of the connection between epistemic justification and the epistemic goal.
• Brogaard, Berit (2006). Can Virtue Reliabilism Explain the Value of Knowledge? Canadian Journal of Philosophy. 36: 3, 335-354.
  • Defends generic reliabilism from the Primary Value Problem; proposes an internalist response to the Secondary Value Problem.
• Brogaard, Berit (2008). The Trivial Argument for Epistemic Value Pluralism, or, How I Learned to Stop Caring About Truth. In: Adrian Haddock, Alan Millar, and Duncan Pritchard, eds. Epistemic Value. Oxford: Oxford University Press. 284-308.
• Carter, J. Adam, Benjamin Jarvis, and Katherine Rubin (2013). Knowledge: Value on the Cheap. Australasian Journal of Philosophy. 91: 2, 249-263.
  • Presents the promising proposal that because knowledge is a continuing state rather than something that is achieved and then set aside, there are easy solutions to the Primary, Secondary, and even Tertiary Value Problems for knowledge.
• Craig, Edward (1990). Knowledge and the State of Nature. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• David, Marian (2001). Truth as the Epistemic Goal. In Matthias Steup, ed., Knowledge, Truth, and Duty: Essays on Epistemic Justification, Responsibility, and Virtue. New York and Oxford: Oxford University Press. 151-169.
  • A thorough discussion of how instrumentalists about epistemic rationality or justification ought to formulate the epistemic goal.
• David, Marian (2005). Truth as the Primary Epistemic Goal: A Working Hypothesis. In Matthias Steup and Ernest Sosa, eds. Contemporary Debates in Epistemology. Malden, MA: Blackwell. 296-312.
• DePaul, Michael (2001). Value Monism in Epistemology. In: Mathhias Steup, ed. Knowledge, Truth, and Duty: Essays on Epistemic Justification, Responsibility, and Virtue. Oxford: Oxford University Press. pp.170-183.
• Dogramaci, Sinan (2012). Reverse Engineering Epistemic Evaluations. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research. 84: 3, 513-530.
  • Accepts the widely-endorsed thought that justification or rationality are only instrumentally valuable for getting us true beliefs. The paper inquires into what function our epistemic practices could serve, in cases where what’s rational to believe is false, or what’s irrational to believe is true.
• Elgin, Catherine (2007). Understanding and the Facts. Philosophical Studies. 132, 33-42.
• Elgin, Catherine (2009). Is Understanding Factive? In A. Haddock, A. Millar, and D. Pritchard, eds. Epistemic Value. Oxford: Oxford University Press. 322-330.
• Feldman, Richard (2000). The Ethics of Belief. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research. 60: 3, 667-695.
• Field, Hartry (2001). Truth and the Absence of Fact. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Among other things, argues that there are no objectively correct epistemic goals which can ground objective judgments of epistemic reasonableness.
• Foley, Richard (1987). The Theory of Epistemic Rationality. Cambridge, Mass: Harvard University Press.
  • A very thorough development of an instrumentalist and egocentric account of epistemic rationality.
• Foley, Richard (1993). Working Without a Net: A Study of Egocentric Rationality. New York and Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Develops and defends the instrumental approach to rationality generally and to epistemic rationality in particular.
• Foley, Richard (2008). An Epistemology that Matters. In P. Weithman, ed. Liberal Faith: Essays in Honor of Philip Quinn. Notre Dame, Indiana: University of Notre Dame Press. 43-55.
  • Clear and succinct statement of Foley’s instrumentalism.
• Godfrey-Smith, Peter (1998). Complexity and the Function of Mind in Nature. Cambridge; Cambridge University Press.
• Goldman, Alvin (1979). What Is Justification? In George Pappas, ed. Justification and Knowledge. Dordrecht: D. Reidel Publishing Company, 1-23.
• Goldman, Alvin (1999). Knowledge in a Social World.
  • Adopts a veritist approach to epistemic value; describes and evaluates a number of key social institutions and practices in light of the truth-goal.
• Goldman, Alvin and Olsson, Erik (2009). Reliabilism and the Value of Knowledge. In A. Haddock, A. Millar, and D. Pritchard, eds. Epistemic Value. Oxford: Oxford University Press. 19-41.
  • Presents two reliabilist responses to the Primary Value Problem.
• Graham, Peter (2011). Epistemic Entitlement. Noûs. 46: 3, 449-482.
• Greco, John (2003). Knowledge as Credit for True Belief. In Michael DePaul and Linda Zagzebski, eds. Intellectual Virtue: Perspectives from Ethics and Epistemology. Oxford: Oxford University Press. 111-134.
  • Sets out the view that attributions of knowledge are attributions of praiseworthiness, when a subject gets credit for getting to the truth as a result of the exercise of intellectual virtues. Discusses praise, blame, and the pragmatics of causal explanations.
• Greco, John (2008). Knowledge and Success from Ability. Philosophical Studies. 142, 17-26.
  • Elaboration of ideas in Greco (2003).
• Grimm, Stephen (2006). Is Understanding a Species of Knowledge? British Journal for the Philosophy of Science. 57, 515–35.
• Grimm, Stephen (2012). The Value of Understanding. Philosophy Compass. 7: 2, 1-3-117.
  • Good survey article of work on the value of understanding up to 2012.
• Haddock, Adrian (2010). Part III: Knowledge and Action. In Duncan Pritchard, Allan Millar, and Adrian Haddock, The Nature and Value of Knowledge: Three Investigations. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Hazlett, Allan (2013). A Luxury of the Understanding: On the Value of True Belief. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • An extended discussion of whether true belief is valuable. Presents a conventionalist account of epistemic normativity.
• Hills, Alison (2009). Moral Testimony and Moral Epistemology. Ethics. 120: 1, 94-127.
• Horvath, Joachim (2009). Why the Conditional Probability Solution to the Swamping Problem Fails. Grazer Philosophische Studien. 79: 1, 115-120.
• Hutchinson, Jim (2021). Why Can’t What Is True Be Valuable? Synthese. 198, 6935-6954.
• Hyman, John (2010). The Road to Larissa. Ratio. 23: 4, 393-414.
  • Contains detailed explanatory and critical discussion of the Primary and Secondary Value Problems, and Plato’s and Williamson’s stability solutions. Proposes that knowledge is the ability to be guided by the facts; and that knowledge is expressed when we guide ourselves by the facts—when we “do things for reasons that are facts” (p.411); and mere true belief is insufficient for this kind of guidance.
• James, William (1949). The Will to Believe. In his Essays in Pragmatism. New York: Hafner. pp. 88-109. Originally published in 1896.
• Jones, Ward (1997). Why Do We Value Knowledge? American Philosophical Quarterly. 34: 4, 423-439.
  • Argues that reliabilists and other instrumentalists cannot handle the Primary Value Problem. Proposes that we solve the problem by appealing to the value of contingent features of knowledge.
• Joyce, James (1998). A Nonpragmatic Vindication of Probabilism. Philosophy of Science. 65: 4, 575-603.
  • Assumes an epistemic goal of truth or accuracy; shows that credal systems that conform to the axioms of probability do better than systems that violate those axioms.
• Kaplan, Mark (1985). It’s Not What You Know that Counts. The Journal of Philosophy. 82: 7, 350-363.
  • Denies that knowledge is any more important than justified true belief.
• Kelly, Thomas (2003). Epistemic Rationality as Instrumental Rationality: A Critique. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research. 66: 3, 612-640.
  • Criticizes the instrumental conception of epistemic rationality, largely on the grounds that beliefs can be epistemically rational or irrational in cases where there is no epistemic goal which the subject desires to achieve.
• Kornblith, Hilary (2002). Knowledge and its Place in Nature. Oxford: Clarendon Press of Oxford University Press.
  • Develops the idea that knowledge is a natural kind which ought to be studied empirically rather than through conceptual analysis. Grounds epistemic norms, including the truth-goal, in the fact that we desire anything at all.
• Kvanvig, Jonathan (2003). The Value of Knowledge and the Pursuit of Understanding. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Considers and rejects various arguments for the value of knowledge. Argues that understanding rather than knowledge is the primary epistemic value.
• Kvanvig, Jonathan (2005). Truth is Not the Primary Epistemic Goal. In Matthias Steup and Ernest Sosa, eds. Contemporary Debates in Epistemology. Malden, MA: Blackwell. 285-296.
  • Criticizes epistemic value monism.
• Kvanvig, Jonathan (2010). The Swamping Problem Redux: Pith and Gist. In Adrian Haddock, Alan Millar, and Duncan Pritchard, eds. Social Epistemology. 89-112.
• Lackey, Jennifer (2007). Why We Don’t Deserve Credit for Everything We Know. Synthese. 158: 3, 345-361.
• Lackey, Jennifer (2009). Knowledge and Credit. Philosophical Studies. 142: 1, 27-42.
• Lackey argues against the virtue-theoretic idea that when S knows that p, S’s getting a true belief is always creditable to S.
• Littlejohn, Clayton (2012). Justification and the Truth-Connection. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Contains an extended discussion of internalism and externalism, and argues against the instrumental conception of epistemic justification. Also argues that there are no false justified beliefs.
• Littlejohn, Clayton (2018). The Right in the Good: A Defense of Teleological Non-Consequentialism. In: Kristoffer Ahlstrom-Vij and Jeffrey Dunn, eds. Epistemic Consequentialism. Oxford: Oxford University Press. 23-47.
• Lynch, Michael (2004). True to Life: Why truth Matters. Cambridge, Mass: MIT Press.
  • Argues for the objective value of true beliefs.
• Lynch, Michael (2009). Truth, Value and Epistemic Expressivism. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research. 79: 1, 76-97.
  • Argues against expressivism and anti-realism about the value of true beliefs.
• Madison, B.J.C. (2017). Epistemic Value and the New Evil Demon. Pacific Philosophical Quarterly. 98: 1, 89-107.
  • Argues that justification is valuable for its own sake, not just as a means to truth.
• Maitzen, Stephen (1995). Our Errant Epistemic Aim. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research. 55: 4, 869-876.
  • Argues that if we take the epistemic goal to be achieving true beliefs and avoiding false ones, then all and only true beliefs will count as justified. Suggests that we need to adopt a different formulation of the goal.
• Millikan, Ruth (1984). Language, Thought, and other Biological Categories. Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press.
  • Develops and applies the selected-effect view of the proper functions of organs and traits.
• Olsson, Erik (2009). In Defense of the Conditional Reliability Solution to the Swamping Problem. Grazer Philosophische Studien. 79: 1, 93-114.
• Olsson, Erik (2011). Reply to Kvanvig on the Swamping Problem. Social Epistemology. 25: 2, 173-182.
• Piller, Christian (2009). Valuing Knowledge: A Deontological Approach. Ethical Theory and Moral Practice. 12, 413-428.
• Plantinga, Alvin (1993). Warrant and Proper Function. New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Develops a proper function analysis of knowledge.
• Plato. Meno. Trans. G. M. A. Grube. In Plato, Complete Works. J. M. Cooper and D. S. Hutcheson, eds. Indianapolis and Cambridge: Hackett, 1997. 870-897.
• Pritchard, Duncan. (2007). Recent Work on Epistemic Value. American Philosophical Quarterly. 44: 2, 85-110.
  • Survey article on problems of epistemic value. Distinguishes Primary, Secondary, and Tertiary value problems.
• Pritchard, Duncan. (2008). Knowing the Answer, Understanding, and Epistemic Value. Grazer Philosophische Studien. 77, 325–39.
• Pritchard, Duncan. (2009). Knowledge, Understanding, and Epistemic Value. Epistemology (Royal Institute of Philosophy Lectures). Ed. Anthony O’Hear. New York: Cambridge University Press. 19–43.
• Pritchard, Duncan. (2010) Part I: Knowledge and Understanding. In Duncan Pritchard, Allan Millar, and Adrian Haddock, The Nature and Value of Knowledge: Three Investigations. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Pritchard, Duncan. (2014). Truth as the Fundamental Epistemic Good. In: Jonathan Matheson and Rico Vitz, eds. The Ethics of Belief: Individual and Social. Oxford:Oxford University Press. 112-129.
• Pritchard, Duncan. (2021). Intellectual Virtues and the Epistemic Value of Truth. Synthese. 198, 5515- 5528.
• Riggs, Wayne (2002). Reliability and the Value of Knowledge. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research. 64, 79-96.
• Riggs, Wayne (2003). Understanding Virtue and the Virtue of Understanding. In Michael DePaul & Linda Zagzebski, eds. Intellectual Virtue: Perspectives from Ethics and Epistemology. Oxford University Press.
• Riggs, Wayne (2008). Epistemic Risk and Relativism. Acta Analytica. vol. 23, no. 1, pp. 1-8.
• Sartwell, Crispin (1991). Knowledge is Merely True Belief. American Philosophical Quarterly. 28: 2, 157-165.
• Sartwell, Crispin  (1992). Why Knowledge is Merely True Belief. The Journal of Philosophy. 89: 4, 167-180.
  • These two articles by Sartwell are the only places in contemporary epistemology where the view that knowledge is just true belief is seriously defended.
• Sliwa, Paulina (2015). Understanding and Knowing. Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society. 115, part 1, pp.57-74.
  • Defends the reductivist thesis that the various types of understanding (understanding a domain, understanding that p, understanding a person, and so on) are no different from the corresponding types of knowing.
• Sosa, Ernest (2003). The Place of Truth in Epistemology. In Michael DePaul and Linda Zagzebski, eds. Intellectual Virtue: Perspectives from Ethics and Epistemology. Oxford: Clarendon Press; New York: Oxford University Press.
• Sosa, Ernest (2007). A Virtue Epistemology: Apt Belief and Reflective Knowledge, Volume 1. Oxford: Clarendon Press; New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Sets out a virtue-theoretic analysis of knowledge. Distinguishes animal knowledge from reflective knowledge. Responds to dream-skepticism. Argues that true belief is the fundamental epistemic value.
• Sylvan, Kurt (2018). Veritism Unswamped. Mind. 127: 506, 381-435.
  • Proposes that justification is non-instrumentally, but still derivatively, valuable.
• Treanor, Nick (2014). Trivial Truths and the Aim of Inquiry. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research. 89: 3, pp.552-559.
  • Argues against an argument for the popular claim that some truths are more interesting than others. Points out that the standard comparisons between what are apparently more and less interesting true sentences are unfair, because the sentences might not involve or express the same number of true propositions.
• Vahid, Hamid (2003). Truth and the Aim of Epistemic Justification. Teorema. 22: 3, 83-91.
  • Discusses justification and the epistemic goal. Proposes that accepting a diachronic formulation of the epistemic goal solves the problem raised by Stephen Maitzen (1995).
• Weiner, Matthew (2009). Practical Reasoning and the Concept of Knowledge. In A. Haddock, A. Millar, and D. Pritchard, eds. Epistemic Value. Oxford: Oxford University Press. 163-182.
  • Argues that knowledge is valuable in the same way as a Swiss Army Knife is valuable. A Swiss Army Knife contains many different blades which are useful in different situations; they’re not always all valuable to have, but it’s valuable to have them all collected in one easy-to-carry package. Similarly, the concept of knowledge has a number of parts which are useful in different situations; they’re not always all valuable in all cases, but it’s useful to have them collected together in one easy-to-use concept.
• Williamson, Timothy (2000). Knowledge and its Limits. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Among many other things, Williamson sets out and defends knowledge-first epistemology, adopts a stability-based solution to the Primary Value Problem, and suggests that his view of knowledge as the most general factive mental state solves the Secondary Value Problem.
• White, R. (2007). Epistemic Subjectivism. Episteme: A Journal of Social Epistemology. 4: 1, 115-129.
• Whiting, Daniel (2012). Epistemic Value and Achievement. Ratio. 25, 216-230.
  • Argues against the view that the value of epistemic states in general should be thought of in terms of achievement (or success because of ability). Also argues against Pritchard’s achievement-account of the value of understanding in particular.
• Wrenn, Chase (2017). True Belief Is Not (Very) Intrinsically Valuable. Pacific Philosophical Quarterly. 98, 108-128.
• Zagzebski, Linda (2001). Recovering Understanding. In Knowledge, Truth, and Duty: Essays on Epistemic Justification, Responsibility, and Virtue. Ed. Matthias Steup. New York: Oxford University Press, 2001. 235–56.
• Zagzebski, Linda (2003). The Search for the Source of Epistemic Good. Metaphilosophy. 34, 12-28.
  • Gives a virtue-theoretic explanation of knowledge and the value of knowledge. Claims that it is morally important to have true beliefs, when we are performing morally important actions. Claims that knowledge is motivated by a love of the truth, and explains the value of knowledge in terms of that love and the value of that love.
• Zagzebski, Linda (2009). On Epistemology. Belmont, CA: Wadsworth.
  • Accessible introduction to contemporary epistemology and to Zagzebski’s preferred views in epistemology. Useful for students and professional philosophers.

Author Information

Patrick Bondy
Email: patrbondy@gmail.com
Cornell University
U. S. A.