Western Theories of Justice

Justice is one of the most important moral and political concepts.  The word comes from the Latin jus, meaning right or law.  The Oxford English Dictionary defines the “just” person as one who typically “does what is morally right” and is disposed to “giving everyone his or her due,” offering the word “fair” as a synonym.  But philosophers want to get beyond etymology and dictionary definitions to consider, for example, the nature of justice as both a moral virtue of character and a desirable quality of political society, as well as how it applies to ethical and social decision-making.  This article will focus on Western philosophical conceptions of justice.  These will be the greatest theories of ancient Greece (those of Plato and Aristotle) and of medieval Christianity (Augustine and Aquinas), two early modern ones (Hobbes and Hume), two from more recent modern times (Kant and Mill), and some contemporary ones (Rawls and several successors).  Typically the article considers not only their theories of justice but also how philosophers apply their own theories to controversial social issues—for example, to civil disobedience, punishment, equal opportunity for women, slavery, war, property rights, and international relations.

For Plato, justice is a virtue establishing rational order, with each part performing its appropriate role and not interfering with the proper functioning of other parts. Aristotle says justice consists in what is lawful and fair, with fairness involving equitable distributions and the correction of what is inequitable.  For Augustine, the cardinal virtue of justice requires that we try to give all people their due; for Aquinas, justice is that rational mean between opposite sorts of injustice, involving proportional distributions and reciprocal transactions.  Hobbes believed justice is an artificial virtue, necessary for civil society, a function of the voluntary agreements of the social contract; for Hume, justice essentially serves public utility by protecting property (broadly understood).  For Kant, it is a virtue whereby we respect others’ freedom, autonomy, and dignity by not interfering with their voluntary actions, so long as those do not violate others’ rights; Mill said justice is a collective name for the most important social utilities, which are conducive to fostering and protecting human liberty.  Rawls analyzed justice in terms of maximum equal liberty regarding basic rights and duties for all members of society, with socio-economic inequalities requiring moral justification in terms of equal opportunity and beneficial results for all; and various post-Rawlsian philosophers develop alternative conceptions.

Western philosophers generally regard justice as the most fundamental of all virtues for ordering interpersonal relations and establishing and maintaining a stable political society.  By tracking the historical interplay of these theories, what will be advocated is a developing understanding of justice in terms of respecting persons as free, rational agents.  One may disagree about the nature, basis, and legitimate application of justice, but this is its core.

Table of Contents

1. Ancient Greece
   1. Plato
   2. Aristotle
2. Medieval Christianity
   1. Augustine
   2. Aquinas
3. Early Modernity
   1. Hobbes
   2. Hume
4. Recent Modernity
   1. Kant
   2. Mill
5. Contemporary Philosophers
   1. Rawls
   2. Post-Rawls
6. References and Further Readings
   1. Primary Sources
   2. Secondary Sources

1. Ancient Greece

For all their originality, even Plato’s and Aristotle’s philosophies did not emerge in a vacuum.  As far back in ancient Greek literature as Homer, the concept of dikaion, used to describe a just person, was important.  From this emerged the general concept of dikaiosune, or justice, as a virtue that might be applied to a political society.  The issue of what does and does not qualify as just could logically lead to controversy regarding the origin of justice, as well as that concerning its essence.  Perhaps an effective aid to appreciating the power of their thought is to view it in the context of the teachings of the Sophists, those itinerant teachers of fifth-century ancient Greece who tried to pass themselves off as “wise” men.  In his trial, Socrates was at pains to dissociate himself from them, after his conviction refusing to save himself, as a typical Sophist would, by employing an act of civil disobedience to escape (Dialogues, pp. 24-26, 52-56; 18b-19d, 50a-54b); Plato is more responsible than anyone else for giving them the bad name that sticks with them to this present time; and Aristotle follows him in having little use for them as instructors of rhetoric, philosophy, values, and the keys to success.  So what did these three great philosophers (literally “lovers of wisdom”) find so ideologically objectionable about the Sophists?  The brief answer is, their relativism and their skepticism.  The first important one, Protagoras, captures the former with his famous saying, “Man is the measure of all things—of the things that are, that they are, and of the things that are not, that they are not”; and he speaks to the latter with a declaration of agnosticism regarding the existence of divinities.  Gorgias (Plato named dialogues after both of them) is remembered for a striking three-part statement of skepticism, holding that nothing really exists, that, even if something did exist, we could not grasp it, and that, even if we could grasp something real, we could never express it to anyone else.  If all values are subjective and/or unknowable, then what counts as just gets reduced to a matter of shifting opinion.  We can easily anticipate how readily Sophists would apply such relativism and skepticism to justice.  For example, Thrasymachus (who figures into the first book of Plato’s Republic) is supposed to have said that there must not be any gods who care about us humans because, while justice is our greatest good, men commonly get away with injustice.  But the most significant Sophist statement regarding justice arguably comes from Antiphon, who employs the characteristic distinction between custom (nomos) and nature (physis) with devastating effect.  He claims that the laws of justice, matters of convention, should be obeyed when other people are observing us and may hold us accountable; but, otherwise, we should follow the demands of nature.  The laws of justice, extrinsically derived, presumably involve serving the good of others, the demands of nature, which are internal, serving self-interest.  He even suggests that obeying the laws of justice often renders us helpless victims of those who do not (First, pp. 211, 232, 274, 264-266).  If there is any such objective value as natural justice, then it is reasonable for us to attempt a rational understanding of it.  On the other hand, if justice is merely a construction of customary agreement, then such a quest is doomed to frustration and failure.  With this as a backdrop, we should be able to see what motivated Plato and Aristotle to seek a strong alternative.

a. Plato

Plato’s masterful Republic (to which we have already referred) is most obviously a careful analysis of justice, although the book is far more wide-ranging than that would suggest.  Socrates, Plato’s teacher and primary spokesman in the dialogue, gets critically involved in a discussion of that very issue with three interlocutors early on.  Socrates provokes Cephalus to say something which he spins into the view that justice simply boils down to always telling the truth and repaying one’s debts.  Socrates easily demolishes this simplistic view with the effective logical technique of a counter-example:  if a friend lends you weapons, when he is sane, but then wants them back to do great harm with them, because he has become insane, surely you should not return them at that time and should even lie to him, if necessary to prevent great harm.  Secondly, Polemarchus, the son of Cephalus, jumps into the discussion, espousing the familiar, traditional view that justice is all about giving people what is their due.  But the problem with this bromide is that of determining who deserves what.  Polemarchus may reflect the cultural influence of the Sophists, in specifying that it depends on whether people are our friends, deserving good from us, or foes, deserving harm.  It takes more effort for Socrates to destroy this conventional theory, but he proceeds in stages:  (1) we are all fallible regarding who are true friends, as opposed to true enemies, so that appearance versus reality makes it difficult to say how we should treat people; (2) it seems at least as significant whether people are good or bad as whether they are our friends or our foes; and (3) it is not at all clear that justice should excuse, let alone require, our deliberately harming anyone (Republic, pp. 5-11; 331b-335e).  If the first inadequate theory of justice was too simplistic, this second one was downright dangerous.

The third, and final, inadequate account presented here is that of the Sophist Thrasymachus.  He roars into the discussion, expressing his contempt for all the poppycock produced thus far and boldly asserting that justice is relative to whatever is advantageous to the stronger people (what we sometimes call the “might makes right” theory).  But who are the “stronger” people?  Thrasymachus cannot mean physically stronger, for then inferior humans would be superior to finer folks like them.  He clarifies his idea that he is referring to politically powerful people in leadership positions.  But, next, even the strongest leaders are sometimes mistaken about what is to their own advantage, raising the question of whether people ought to do what leaders suppose is to their own advantage or only what actually is so.  (Had Thrasymachus phrased this in terms of what serves the interest of society itself, the same appearance versus reality distinction would apply.)  But, beyond this, Socrates rejects the exploitation model of leadership, which sees political superiors as properly exploiting inferiors (Thrasymachus uses the example of a shepherd fattening up and protecting his flock of sheep for his own selfish gain), substituting a service model in its place (his example is of the good medical doctor, who practices his craft primarily for the welfare of patients).  So, now, if anything like this is to be accepted as our model for interpersonal relations, then Thrasymachus embraces the “injustice” of self-interest as better than serving the interests of others in the name of “justice.”  Well, then, how are we to interpret whether the life of justice or that of injustice is better?  Socrates suggests three criteria for judgment:  which is the smarter, which is the more secure, and which is the happier way of life; he argues that the just life is better on all three counts.  Thus, by the end of the first book, it looks as if Socrates has trounced all three of these inadequate views of justice, although he himself claims to be dissatisfied because we have only shown what justice is not, with no persuasive account of its actual nature (ibid., pp. 14-21, 25-31; 338c-345b, 349c-354c).  Likewise, in Gorgias, Plato has Callicles espouse the view that, whatever conventions might seem to dictate, natural justice dictates that superior people should rule over and derive greater benefits than inferior people, that society artificially levels people because of a bias in favor of equality.  Socrates is then made to criticize this theory by analyzing what sort of superiority would be relevant and then arguing that Callicles is erroneously advocating injustice, a false value, rather than the genuine one of true justice (Gorgias, pp. 52-66; 482d-493c; see, also, Laws, pp. 100-101, 172; 663, 714 for another articulation of something like Thrasymachus’ position).

In the second book of Plato’s Republic, his brothers, Glaucon and Adeimantus, take over the role of primary interlocutors.  They quickly make it clear that they are not satisfied with Socrates’ defense of justice.  Glaucon reminds us that there are three different sorts of goods—intrinsic ones, such as joy, merely instrumental ones, such as money-making, and ones that are both instrumentally and intrinsically valuable, such as health—in order to ask which type of good is justice.  Socrates responds that justice belongs in the third category, rendering it the richest sort of good.  In that case, Glaucon protests, Socrates has failed to prove his point.  If his debate with Thrasymachus accomplished anything at all, it nevertheless did not establish any intrinsic value in justice.  So Glaucon will play devil’s advocate and resurrect the Sophist position, in order to challenge Socrates to refute it in its strongest form.  He proposes to do this in three steps:  first, he will argue that justice is merely a conventional compromise (between harming others with impunity and being their helpless victims), agreed to by people for their own selfish good and socially enforced (this is a crude version of what will later become the social contract theory of justice in Hobbes); second, he illustrates our allegedly natural selfish preference for being unjust if we can get away with it by the haunting story of the ring of Gyges, which provides its wearer with the power to become invisible at will and, thus, to get away with the most wicked of injustices—to which temptation everyone would, sooner or later, rationally succumb; and, third, he tries to show that it is better to live unjustly than justly if one can by contrasting the unjust person whom everyone thinks just with the just person who is thought to be unjust, claiming that, of course, it would be better to be the former than the latter.  Almost as soon as Glaucon finishes, his brother Adeimantus jumps in to add two more points to the case against justice:  first, parents instruct their children to behave justly not because it is good in itself but merely because it tends to pay off for them; and, secondly, religious teachings are ineffective in encouraging us to avoid injustice because the gods will punish it and to pursue justice because the gods will reward it, since the gods may not even exist or, if they do, they may well not care about us or, if they are concerned about human behavior, they can be flattered with prayers and bribed with sacrifices to let us get away with wrongdoing (Republic, pp. 33-42; 357b-366e).  So the challenge for Socrates posed by Plato’s brothers is to show the true nature of justice and that it is intrinsically valuable rather than only desirable for its contingent consequences.

In defending justice against this Sophist critique, Plato has Socrates construct his own positive theory.  This is set up by means of an analogy comparing justice, on the large scale, as it applies to society, and on a smaller scale, as it applies to an individual soul.  Thus justice is seen as an essential virtue of both a good political state and a good personal character.  The strategy hinges on the idea that the state is like the individual writ large—each comprising three main parts such that it is crucial how they are interrelated—and that analyzing justice on the large scale will facilitate our doing so on the smaller one.  In Book IV, after cobbling together his blueprint of the ideal republic, Socrates asks Glaucon where justice is to be found, but they agree they will have to search for it together.  They agree that, if they have succeeded in establishing the foundations of a “completely good” society, it would have to comprise four pivotal virtues:  wisdom, courage, temperance, and justice.  If they can properly identify the other three of those four, whatever remains that is essential to a completely good society must be justice.  Wisdom is held to be prudent judgment among leaders; courage is the quality in defenders or protectors whereby they remain steadfast in their convictions and commitments in the face of fear; and temperance (or moderation) is the virtue to be found in all three classes of citizens, but especially in the producers, allowing them all to agree harmoniously that the leaders should lead and everyone else follow.  So now, by this process-of-elimination analysis, whatever is left that is essential to a “completely good” society will allegedly be justice.  It then turns out that “justice is doing one’s own work and not meddling with what isn’t one’s own.”  So the positive side of socio-political justice is each person doing the tasks assigned to him or her; the negative side is not interfering with others doing their appointed tasks.  Now we move from this macro-level of political society to the psychological micro-level of an individual soul, pressing the analogy mentioned above.  Plato has Socrates present an argument designed to show that reason in the soul, corresponding to the leaders or “guardians” of the state, is different from both the appetites, corresponding to the productive class, and the spirited part of the soul, corresponding to the state’s defenders or “auxiliaries” and that the appetites are different from spirit.  Having established the parallel between the three classes of the state and the three parts of the soul, the analogy suggests that a “completely good” soul would also have to have the same four pivotal virtues.  A good soul is wise, in having good judgment whereby reason rules; it is courageous in that its spirited part is ready, willing, and able to fight for its convictions in the face of fear; and it is temperate or moderate, harmoniously integrated because all of its parts, especially its dangerous appetitive desires, agree that it should be always under the command of reason.  And, again, what is left that is essential is justice, whereby each part of the soul does the work intended by nature, none of them interfering with the functioning of any other parts.  We are also told in passing that, corresponding to these four pivotal virtues of the moral life, there are four pivotal vices, foolishness, cowardice, self-indulgence, and injustice.  One crucial question remains unanswered:  can we show that justice, thus understood, is better than injustice in itself and not merely for its likely consequences?  The answer is that, of course, we can because justice is the health of the soul.  Just as health is intrinsically and not just instrumentally good, so is justice; injustice is a disease—bad and to be avoided even if it isn’t yet having any undesirable consequences, even if nobody is aware of it (ibid., pp. 43, 102-121; 368d, 427d-445b; it can readily be inferred that this conception of justice is non-egalitarian; but, to see this point made explicitly, see Laws, pp. 229-230; 756-757).

Now let us quickly see how Plato applies this theory of justice to a particular social issue, before briefly considering the theory critically.  In a remarkably progressive passage in Book V of his Republic, Plato argues for equal opportunity for women.  He holds that, even though women tend to be physically weaker than men, this should not prove an insuperable barrier to their being educated for the same socio-political functions as men, including those of the top echelons of leadership responsibility.  While the body has a gender, it is the soul that is virtuous or vicious.  Despite their different roles in procreation, child-bearing, giving birth, and nursing babies, there is no reason, in principle, why a woman should not be as intelligent and virtuous—including as just—as men, if properly trained.  As much as possible, men and women should share the workload in common (Republic, pp. 125-131; 451d-457d).  We should note, however, that the rationale is the common good of the community rather than any appeal to what we might consider women’s rights.  Nevertheless, many of us today are sympathetic to this application of justice in support of a view that would not become popular for another two millennia.

What of Plato’s theory of justice itself?  The negative part of it—his critique of inadequate views of justice—is a masterful series of arguments against attempts to reduce justice to a couple of simplistic rules (Cephalus), to treating people merely in accord with how we feel about them (Polemarchus), and to the power-politics mentality of exploiting them for our own selfish purposes (Thrasymachus).  All of these views of a just person or society introduce the sort of relativism and/or subjectivism we have identified with the Sophists.  Thus, in refuting them, Plato, in effect, is refuting the Sophists.  However, after the big buildup, the positive part—what he himself maintains justice is—turns out to be a letdown.  His conception of justice reduces it to order.  While some objective sense of order is relevant to justice, this does not adequately capture the idea of respecting all persons, individually and collectively, as free rational agents.  The analogy between the state and the soul is far too fragile to support the claim that they must agree in each having three “parts.”  The process-of-elimination approach to determining the nature of justice only works if those four virtues exhaust the list of what is essential here.  But do they?  What, for example, of the Christian virtue of love or the secular virtue of benevolence?  Finally, the argument from analogy, showing that justice must be intrinsically, and not merely instrumentally, valuable (because it is like the combination good of health) proves, on critical consideration, to fail.  Plato’s theory is far more impressive than the impressionistic view of the Sophists; and it would prove extremely influential in advocating justice as an objective, disinterested value.  Nevertheless, one cannot help hoping that a more cogent theory might yet be developed.

b. Aristotle

After working with Plato at his Academy for a couple of decades, Aristotle was understandably most influenced by his teacher, also adopting, for example, a virtue theory of ethics.  Yet part of Aristotle’s greatness stems from his capacity for critical appropriation, and he became arguably Plato’s most able critic as well as his most famous follower in wanting to develop a credible alternative to Sophism.  Book V of his great Nicomachean Ethics deals in considerable depth with the moral and political virtue of justice.  It begins vacuously enough with the circular claim that it is the condition that renders us just agents inclined to desire and practice justice.  But his analysis soon becomes more illuminating when he specifies it in terms of what is lawful and fair.  What is in accordance with the law of a state is thought to be conducive to the common good and/or to that of its rulers.  In general, citizens should obey such law in order to be just.  The problem is that civil law can itself be unjust in the sense of being unfair to some, so that we need to consider special justice as a function of fairness.  He analyzes this into two sorts:  distributive justice involves dividing benefits and burdens fairly among members of a community, while corrective justice requires us, in some circumstances, to try to restore a fair balance in interpersonal relations where it has been lost.  If a member of a community has been unfairly benefited or burdened with more or less than is deserved in the way of social distributions, then corrective justice can be required, as, for example, by a court of law.  Notice that Aristotle is no more an egalitarian than Plato was—while a sort of social reciprocity may be needed, it must be of a proportional sort rather than equal.  Like all moral virtues, for Aristotle, justice is a rational mean between bad extremes.  Proportional equality or equity involves the “intermediate” position between someone’s unfairly getting “less” than is deserved and unfairly getting “more” at another’s expense.  The “mean” of justice lies between the vices of getting too much and getting too little, relative to what one deserves, these being two opposite types of injustice, one of “disproportionate excess,” the other of disproportionate “deficiency” (Nicomachean, pp. 67-74, 76; 1129a-1132b, 1134a).

Political justice, of both the lawful and the fair sort, is held to apply only to those who are citizens of a political community (a polis) by virtue of being “free and either proportionately or numerically equal,” those whose interpersonal relations are governed by the rule of law, for law is a prerequisite of political justice and injustice.  But, since individuals tend to be selfishly biased, the law should be a product of reason rather than of particular rulers.  Aristotle is prepared to distinguish between what is naturally just and unjust, on the one hand, such as whom one may legitimately kill, and what is merely conventionally just or unjust, on the other, such as a particular system of taxation for some particular society.  But the Sophists are wrong to suggest that all political justice is the artificial result of legal convention and to discount all universal natural justice (ibid., pp. 77-78; 1134a-1135a; cf. Rhetoric, pp. 105-106; 1374a-b).  What is allegedly at stake here is our developing a moral virtue that is essential to the well-being of society, as well as to the flourishing of any human being.  Another valuable dimension of Aristotle’s discussion here is his treatment of the relationship between justice and decency, for sometimes following the letter of the law would violate fairness or reasonable equity.  A decent person might selfishly benefit from being a stickler regarding following the law exactly but decide to take less or give more for the sake of the common good.  In this way, decency can correct the limitations of the law and represents a higher form of justice (Nicomachean, pp. 83-84; 1137a-1138a).

In his Politics, Aristotle further considers political justice and its relation to equality.  We can admit that the former involves the latter but must carefully specify by maintaining that justice involves equality “not for everyone, only for equals.”  He agrees with Plato that political democracy is intrinsically unjust because, by its very nature, it tries to treat unequals as if they were equals.  Justice rather requires inequality for people who are unequal.  But, then, oligarchy is also intrinsically unjust insofar as it involves treating equals as unequal because of some contingent disparity, of birth, wealth, etc.  Rather, those in a just political society who contribute the most to the common good will receive a larger share, because they thus exhibit more political virtue, than those who are inferior in that respect; it would be simply wrong, from the perspective of political justice, for them to receive equal shares.  Thus political justice must be viewed as a function of the common good of a community.  It is the attempt to specify the equality or inequality among people, he admits, that constitutes a key “problem” of “political philosophy.”  He thinks we can all readily agree that political justice requires “proportional” rather than numerical equality.  But inferiors have a vested interest in thinking that those who are equal in some respect should be equal in all respects, while superiors are biased, in the opposite direction, to imagine that those who are unequal in some way should be unequal in all ways.  Thus, for instance, those who are equally citizens are not necessarily equal in political virtue, and those who are financially richer are not necessarily morally or mentally superior.  What is relevant here is “equality according to merit,” though Aristotle cannot precisely specify what, exactly, counts as merit, for how much it must count, who is to measure it, and by what standard.  All he can suggest, for example in some of his comments on the desirable aristocratic government, is that it must involve moral and intellectual virtue (Politics, pp. 79, 81, 86, 134, 136, 151, 153; 1280a, 1281a, 1282b, 1301a-1302a, 1307a, 1308a).

Let us now consider how Aristotle applies his own theory of justice to the social problem of alleged superiors and inferiors, before attempting a brief critique of that theory.  While Plato accepted slavery as a legitimate social institution but argued for equal opportunity for women, in his Politics, Aristotle accepts sexual inequality while actively defending slavery.  Anyone who is inferior intellectually and morally is properly socio-politically inferior in a well-ordered polis.  A human being can be naturally autonomous or not, “a natural slave” being defective in rationality and morality, and thus naturally fit to belong to a superior; such a human can rightly be regarded as “a piece of property,” or another person’s “tool for action.”  Given natural human inequality, it is allegedly inappropriate that all should rule or share in ruling.  Aristotle holds that some are marked as superior and fit to rule from birth, while others are inferior and marked from birth to be ruled by others.  This supposedly applies not only to ethnic groups, but also to the genders, and he unequivocally asserts that males are “naturally superior” and females “naturally inferior,” the former being fit to rule and the latter to be ruled.  The claim is that it is naturally better for women themselves that they be ruled by men, as it is better for “natural slaves” that they should be ruled by those who are “naturally free.”  Now Aristotle does argue only for natural slavery.  It was the custom (notice the distinction, used here, between custom and nature) in antiquity to make slaves of conquered enemies who become prisoners of war.  But Aristotle (like Plato) believes that Greeks are born for free and rational self-rule, unlike non-Greeks (“barbarians”), who are naturally inferior and incapable of it.  So the fact that a human being is defeated or captured is no assurance that he is fit for slavery, as an unjust war may have been imposed on a nobler society by a more primitive one.  While granting that Greeks and non-Greeks, as well as men and women, are all truly human, Aristotle justifies the alleged inequality among them based on what he calls the “deliberative” capacity of their rational souls.  The natural slave’s rational soul supposedly lacks this, a woman has it but it lacks the authority for her to be autonomous, a (free male) child has it in some developmental stage, and a naturally superior free male has it developed and available for governance (ibid., pp. 7-11, 23; 1254a-1255a, 1260a).

This application creates a helpful path to a critique of Aristotle’s theory of justice.  If we feel that it is unjust to discriminate against people merely on account of their gender and/or ethnic origin, as philosophers, we try to identify the rational root of the problem.  If our moral intuitions are correct against Aristotle (and some would even call his views here sexist and racist), he may be mistaken about a matter of fact or about a value judgment or both.  Surely he is wrong about all women and non-Greeks, as such, being essentially inferior to Greek males in relevant ways, for cultural history has demonstrated that, when given opportunities, women and non-Greeks have shown themselves to be significantly equal.  But it appears that Aristotle may also have been wrong in leaping from the factual claim of inequality to the value judgment that it is therefore right that inferiors ought to be socially, legally, politically, and economically subordinate—like Plato and others of his culture (for which he is an apologist here), Aristotle seems to have no conception of human rights as such.  Like Plato, he is arguing for an objective theory of personal and social justice as a preferable alternative to the relativistic one of the Sophists.  Even though there is something attractive about Aristotle’s empirical (as opposed to Plato’s idealistic) approach to justice, it condemns him to the dubious position of needing to derive claims about how things ought to be from factual claims about the way things actually are.  It also leaves Aristotle with little viable means of establishing a universal perspective that will respect the equal dignity of all humans, as such.  Thus his theory, like Plato’s, fails adequately to respect all persons as free, rational agents.  They were so focused on the ways in which people are unequal, that they could not appreciate any fundamental moral equality that might provide a platform for natural human rights.

2. Medieval Christianity

When Christian thinkers sought to develop their own philosophies in the middle ages (“medieval” meaning the middle ages and “middle” in the sense of being between antiquity and modernity), they found precious basic building-blocks in ancient thought.  This included such important post-Aristotelians as the enormously influential Roman eclectic Cicero, such prominent Stoics as Marcus Aurelius (a Roman emperor) and Epictetus (a Greek slave of the Romans), and neo-Platonists like Plotinus.  But the two dominant paths that medieval philosophy would follow for its roughly thousand year history had been blazed by Plato and Aristotle.  More specifically, Augustine uses Platonic (and neo-Platonic) philosophy to the extent that he can reconcile it with Christian thought; Aquinas, many centuries later, develops a great synthesis of Christian thought (including that of Augustine) and Aristotelian philosophy.  A great difference, however, between their philosophies and those of Hellenic thinkers such as Plato and Aristotle stems from the commitment of these Christians to the authority of the Hebrew and Christian scriptures.  Aquinas would later agree with Augustine (who is accepting the mandate of Isaiah 7:9) that the quest for philosophical understanding should begin with belief in religious traditions (Choice, pp. 3, 32).  Both the Old Testament and the New Testament call for just behavior on the part of righteous people, with injustice being a sin against God’s law, the references being too numerous to cite (but see Job 9:2, Proverbs 4:18, Proverbs 10:6-7, Ecclesiastes 7:20, Matthew 5:45, Philippians 4:8, and Hebrews 12:23).  The claim that God’s justice will prevail in the form of divine judgment is both a promise for the just and a threat for the unjust.  Righteousness is identified with mercy as well as with justice (e.g., Micah 6:8 and Matthew 5:7) and involves our relationship with God as well as with fellow humans.  The ten commandments of the Old Testament (Exodus 20:1-17) are prescriptions regarding how the righteous are to relate to God as well as to one another.  In the New Testament, Jesus of Nazareth interprets how the righteous are to live (Matthew 22:36-40) in terms of love of both God and their neighbors; the concept of one’s neighbor is meant to extend even to strangers, as is illustrated in the parable of the Good Samaritan (Luke 10:29-37).  In the Beatitudes beginning the Sermon on the Mount, Jesus expands on this gospel of love by advocating that his followers go beyond the duties of justice to behave with compassion in certain supererogatory ways (Matthew 5:3-12).  All of this scriptural tradition essentially influenced medieval thinkers such as Augustine and Aquinas in a way that distinguishes them from ancient Greek philosophers such as Plato and Aristotle.

a. Augustine

Aurelius Augustine was born and raised in the Roman province of North Africa; during his life, he experienced the injustices, the corruption, and the erosion of the Roman Empire.  This personal experience, in dialectical tension with the ideals of Christianity, provided him with a dramatic backdrop for his religious axiology.  Philosophically, he was greatly influenced by such neo-Platonists as Plotinus.  His Christian Platonism is evident in his philosophical dialogue On Free Choice of the Will, in which he embraces Plato’s view of four central moral virtues (which came to be called “cardinal,” from the Latin word for hinges, these being metaphorically imaginable as the four hinges on which the door of morality pivots).  These are prudence (substituted for wisdom), fortitude or courage, temperance, and justice.  His conception of justice is the familiar one of “the virtue by which all people are given their due.”  But this is connected to something new and distinctly Christian—the distinction between the temporal law, such as the law of the state, and the eternal, divine law of God.  The eternal law establishes the order of God’s divine providence.  And, since all temporal or human law must be consistent with God’s eternal law, Augustine can draw the striking conclusion that, strictly speaking, “an unjust law is no law at all,” an oxymoron (Choice, pp. 20, 11, 8; cf. Religion, p. 89, for an analysis of justice that relates it to love).  Thus a civil law of the state that violates God’s eternal law is not morally binding and can be legitimately disobeyed in good conscience.  This was to have a profound and ongoing influence on Christian ethics.

In his masterpiece, The City of God, Augustine draws the dramatic conclusion from this position that the Roman Empire was never a truly just political society.  He expresses his disgust over its long history of “revolting injustice.”  Rome was always a pagan, earthly city, and “true justice” can allegedly only be found in a Christian “city of God.”  The just, rather than the powerful, should rule for the common good, rather than serving their own self-interest.  He strikingly compares unjust societies, based on might rather than on right, to “gangs of criminals on a large scale,” for, without justice, a kingdom or empire is merely ruled by the arbitrary fiat of some leader(s).  A genuinely just society must be based on Christian love, its peaceful order established by the following of two basic rules—that people harm nobody and that they should try to help everyone to the extent that they can do so (City, pp. 75, 67, 75, 138-139, 873).

Despite his Christian commitment to love and peace, Augustine is not a pacifist and can support “just wars” as morally permissible and even as morally obligatory.  Every war aims at the order of some sort of established peace; while an unjust war aims to establish an unjust peace of domination, a just war aims to establish a “just peace.”  He agrees with Cicero that a just war must be defensive rather than aggressive (ibid., pp. 861-862, 866, 868-869, 1031).  In a letter (# 138) to Marcellinus, Augustine uses scripture to deny that Christian doctrine is committed to pacifism, though wars should be waged, when necessary, with a benevolent love for the enemy.  In a letter (# 189) to Boniface, he maintains that godly, righteous people can serve in the military, again citing scripture to support his position.  He repeats the view that a just war should aim at establishing a lasting and just peace and holds that one must keep faith with both one’s allies and one’s enemies, even in the awful heat of warfare.  Augustine’s most important treatment of the just war theory is contained in his writing Against Faustus the Manichean, where he analyzes the evils of war in terms of the desire to harm others, the lust for revenge and cruelty, and the wish to dominate other people.  In addition to the condition that a just war must aim at establishing a just and lasting peace, a second condition is that it must be declared by a leader or body of leaders, with the “authority” to do so, after deliberating that it is justified.  Again Augustine makes it clear that he is no pacifist (Political, pp. 209, 219-223).

While this is a very valuable application of his theory of justice, this doctrine of the just war standing the test of time to this very day, the general theory on which it is based is more problematic.  The unoriginal (and uninspired) conception of justice as giving others their due had already become familiar to the point of being trite.  It remains vulnerable to the serious problems of vagueness already considered:  what is the relevant criterion whereby it should be determined who deserves what, and who is fit to make such a judgment?  But, also, Augustine should have an advantage over the ancient Greeks in arriving at a theory of justice based on universal equality on account of the Christian doctrine (not to mention because of the influences of Cicero, the Stoics, and Plotinus) that all humans are equally children of God.  Unfortunately, his zealous Christian evangelism leads him to identify justice itself, in a divisive, intolerant, polemical way, with the Christian church’s idea of what God requires, so that only a Christian society can possibly qualify as just, as if a just political society would need to be a theocracy.  Thus, while he has some sense of some moral or spiritual equality among humans, it does not issue in equal respect for all persons as free, rational agents, allowing him, for example, to accept the institution of slavery as a just punishment for sin, despite the belief that God originally created humans as naturally free, because of the idea that we have all been corrupted by original sin (City, pp. 874-875).

b. Aquinas

As Augustine is arguably the greatest Christian Platonist, so Thomas Aquinas, from what is now Italy, is the greatest Christian Aristotelian.  Nevertheless, as we shall see, his theory of justice is also quite compatible with Augustine’s.  Aquinas discusses the same four cardinal moral virtues, including that of justice, in his masterpiece, the multi-volume Summa Theologica.  No more a socio-political egalitarian than Plato, Aristotle, or Augustine, he analyzes it as calling for proportional equality, or equity, rather than any sort of strict numerical equality, and as a function of natural right rather than of positive law.  Natural right ultimately stems from the eternal, immutable will of God, who created the world and governs it with divine providence.  Natural justice must always take precedence over the contingent agreements of our human conventions.  Human law must never contravene natural law, which is reason’s way of understanding God’s eternal law.  He offers us an Aristotelian definition, maintaining that “justice is a habit whereby a man renders to each one his due by a constant and perpetual will.”  As a follower of Aristotle, he defines concepts in terms of genus and species.  In this case, the general category to which justice belongs is that it is a moral habit of a virtuous character.  What specifically distinguishes it from other moral virtues is that by justice, a person is consistently committed to respecting the rights of others over time.  Strictly speaking, the virtue of justice always concerns interpersonal relations, so that it is only metaphorically that we can speak of a person being just to himself.  In addition to legal justice, whereby a person is committed to serving the “common good” of the entire community, there is “particular justice,” which requires that we treat individuals in certain ways.  Justice is a rational mean between the vicious extremes of deficiency and excess, having to do with our external actions regarding others.  Like many of his predecessors, Aquinas considers justice to be preeminent among the moral virtues.  He agrees with Aristotle in analyzing particular justice into two types, which he calls “distributive” and “commutative”; the former governs the proportional distribution of common goods, while the latter concerns the reciprocal dealings between individuals in their voluntary transactions (Law, pp. 137, 139, 145, 147, 155, 160, 163, 165).

Aquinas applies this theory of justice to many social problems.  He maintains that natural law gives us the right to own private property.  Given this natural right, theft (surreptitiously stealing another’s property) and robbery (taking it openly by force or the threat of violence) must be unjust, although an exception can arise if the thief and his family are starving in an environment of plenty, in which case, stealing is justified and, strictly speaking, not theft or robbery at all.  Secondly, Aquinas refines the Augustinian just war theory by articulating three conditions that must jointly be met in order for the waging of war to be just:  (a) it must be declared by a leader with socio-political authority; (b) it must be declared for a “just cause,” in that the people attacked must be at fault and thus deserve it; and (c) those going to war must intend good and the avoidance of evil.  It is not justifiable deliberately to slay innocent noncombatants.  It is legitimate to kill another in self-defense, though one’s intention should be that of saving oneself, the taking of the other’s life merely being the necessary means to that good end (this, by the way, is the source of what later evolves into the moral principle of “double effect”).  Even acting in self-defense must be done in reasonable proportion to the situation, so that it is wrong to employ more force than is necessary to stop aggression.  Even killing another unintentionally can be unjust if done in the course of committing another crime or through criminal negligence.  Thirdly, while Aquinas thinks we should tolerate the religious beliefs of those who have never been Christians, so that it would be unjust to persecute them, he thinks it just to use force against heretics who adhered to but then rejected orthodox Christianity, even to the point of hurting them, as in the Inquisition, for the good of their own souls.  In an extreme case of recalcitrant heretics who will not be persuaded to return to the truth of Christianity, it is allegedly just that they should be “exterminated” by execution rather than being allowed to corrupt other Christians by espousing their heterodox religious views.  Fourth, like Augustine, Aquinas accepts slavery, so long as no Christian is the slave of a non-Christian (ibid., pp. 178-183, 186, 221, 224, 226, 228, 250, 256, 253), and considers it just that women should be politically and economically “subject” to men.  Although he considers women to be fully human, he agrees with Aristotle that they are “defective and misbegotten,” the consequence allegedly being inferior rational discretion (Summa, pp. 466-467).

From a critical perspective, his general theory of justice is, by now, quite familiar, a sort of blend of Aristotle’s and Augustine’s, and marked by the same flaws as theirs.  His applications of the theory can be regarded as indicative of its problematic character:  (a) given the assumption of a right to own private property, his discussion of the injustices of theft and robbery seems quite reasonable; (b) assuming that we have a right to self-defense, his analysis of the legitimacy of killing in a just war does also; (c) his attempted defense of the persecution of religious heretics, even unto death, invites suspicions of dogmatic, intolerant fanaticism on his part; and (d) his acceptance of slavery and the political and economic subjection of women as just is indicative of an empirical orientation that is too uncritically accepting of the status quo.  Here again the Christian belief that all humans are personal creatures of a loving God is vitiated by an insufficient commitment to the implications of that, regarding socio-political equality, so that only some humans are fully respected as free, rational agents.  The rationalistic theories of Plato and Augustine and the classical empirical theories of Aristotle and Aquinas all leave us hoping that preferable alternatives might be forthcoming.

3. Early Modernity

Although only half as much time elapses between Aquinas and Hobbes as did between Augustine and Aquinas, from the perspective of intellectual history, the period of modernism represents a staggering sea-change.  We have neither the time nor the space to consider the complex causal nexus that explains this fact; but, for our purposes, suffice it to say that the Protestant Reformation, the revolution of the new science, and the progressive willingness publicly to challenge authority (both political and religious) converge to generate a strikingly different philosophical mentality in the seventeenth century.  In the previous century, the Protestant Reformation shattered the hegemony of the Roman Catholic Church, so that thinkers need not feel so constrained to adhere to established orthodoxy.  The naturalistic worldview of the sixteenth and early seventeenth centuries that eventuated in an empirical and experimental (non-dogmatic) methodology in both natural and political science set an example for philosophers.  Thinkers of the modern era became increasingly comfortable breaking from the mainstream to pursue their own independent reasoning.  Although the influence of great ancient philosophers like Plato and Aristotle and of great medieval thinkers such as Augustine and Aquinas would persist, there was no returning to their bygone perspectives.  This vitally affects moral and political theory, in general, and views on justice, in particular.  As we shall see in this section, views of justice as relative to human needs and interests became prominent as they had not been for a couple of millennia.  This will locate Hobbes and Hume closer to the Sophists than had been fashionable since pre-Socratic times in philosophy, regarding justice as a social construct.

a. Hobbes

Whereas Plato, Aristotle, Augustine, and Aquinas all offer accounts of justice that represent alternatives to Sophism, Thomas Hobbes, the English radical empiricist, can be seen as resurrecting the Sophist view that we can have no objective knowledge of it as a moral or political absolute value.  His radical empiricism does not allow him to claim to know anything not grounded in concrete sense experience.  This leads him in Leviathan, his masterpiece, to conclude that anything real must be material or corporeal in nature, that body is the one and only sort of reality; this is the philosophical position of materialistic monism, which rules out the possibility of any spiritual substance.  On this view, “a man is a living body,” only different in kind from other animals, but with no purely spiritual soul separating him from the beasts.  Like other animals, man is driven by instinct and appetite, his reason being a capacity of his brain for calculating means to desirable ends.  Another controversial claim here is that all actions, including all human actions, are causally determined to occur as they do by the complex of their antecedent conditions; this is causal determinism.  What we consider voluntary actions are simply those we perform in which the will plays a significant causal role, human freedom amounting to nothing more exalted than the absence of external restraints.  Like other animals, we are always fundamentally motivated by a survival instinct and ultimately driven by self-interest in all of our voluntary actions; this is psychological egoism.  It is controversial whether he also holds that self-interest should always be our fundamental motivation, which is ethical egoism.  In his most famous Chapter XIII, Hobbes paints a dramatic and disturbing portrait of what human life would be like in a state of nature—that is, beyond the conventional order of civil society.  We would be rationally distrustful of one another, inclined to be anti-social, viewing others as threats to our own satisfaction and well-being.  Interpersonal antagonism would be natural; and, since there would exist no moral distinctions between right and wrong, just and unjust, violent force and fraudulent deception would be desirable virtues rather than objectionable vices.  In short, this would be a state of “war of every man against every man,” a condition in which we could not reasonably expect to survive for long or to enjoy any quality of life for as long as we did.  We are smart enough to realize that this would be a condition in which, as Hobbes famously writes, “the life of man” would inevitably be “solitary, poor, nasty, brutish, and short.”  Fortunately, our natural passions of fear, desire, and hope motivate us to use reason to calculate how we might escape this hellish state.  Reason discovers a couple of basic laws of nature, indicating how we should prudently behave if we are to have any reasonable opportunity to survive, let alone to thrive.  The first of these is double-sided:  the positive side holds that we should try to establish peace with others, for our own selfish good, if we can; the negative side holds that, if we cannot do that, then we should do whatever it takes to destroy whoever might be a threat to our interests.  The second law of nature maintains that, in order to achieve peace with others, we must be willing to give up our right to harm them, so long as they agree to reciprocate by renouncing their right to harm us.  This “mutual transferring of right,” established by reciprocal agreement, is the so-called social contract that constitutes the basis of civil society; and the agreement can be made either explicitly or implicitly (Leviathan, pp. 261-262, 459-460, 79, 136, 82, 95, 74-78, 80-82; for comparable material, see Elements, pp. 78-84, 103-114, as well as Citizen, pp. 109-119, 123-124).

What is conspicuously missing here is any sense of natural justice or injustice.  In the state of nature, all moral values are strictly relative to our desires:  whatever seems likely to satisfy our desires appears “good” to us, and whatever seems likely to frustrate our desires we regard as “evil.”  It’s all relative to what we imaginatively associate with our own appetites and aversions.  But as we move from this state of nature to the state of civil society by means of the social contract, we create the rules of justice by means of the agreements we strike with one another.  Prior to the conventions of the contract, we were morally free to try to do whatever we wished.  But when a covenant is made, then to break it is unjust; and the definition of injustice is no other than the not performance of covenant.  What is not unjust, is just in civil society.  This turns out to be the third law of nature, that, in the name of justice, we must try to keep our agreements.  In civil society, we may justly do anything we have not, at least implicitly, committed ourselves not to do.  A just person typically does just actions, though committing one or a few unjust actions does not automatically render that person unjust, especially if the unjust behavior stems from an error or sudden passion; on the other hand, a person who is typically inclined to commit unjust actions is a guilty person.  Still, if we are as selfishly motivated by our own desires as Hobbes maintains, why should we not break our word and voluntarily commit injustice, if doing so is likely to pay off for us and we imagine we might get away with it (remember the problem posed by Glaucon with the story of the ring of Gyges)?  Clearly one more element is needed to prevent the quick disintegration of the rules of justice so artificially constructed by interpersonal agreement.  This is the power of sovereign authority.  We need laws codifying the rules of justice; and they must be so vigilantly and relentlessly enforced by absolute political power that nobody in his right mind would dare to try to violate them.  People simply cannot be trusted to honor their social commitments without being forced to do so, since “covenants without the sword are but words, and of no strength to secure a man at all.”  In other words, we must sacrifice a great deal of our natural liberty to achieve the sort of security without which life is hardly worth living.  In civil society, our freedom is relative to the lack of specified obligations, what Hobbes calls “the silence of the law.”  If we worry that this invests too much power in the government, which may abuse that power and excessively trample on our freedom, the (cynical) response is that this is preferable to the chaos of the state of nature or to the horrors of civil war (Leviathan, pp. 28-29, 89, 93, 106, 109, 143, 117; for comparable material, see Elements, pp. 88-89, Citizen, pp. 136-140, and Common, p. 34).  One of the most crucial problems of political philosophy is where to strike the balance between personal liberty and public order; Hobbes is, perhaps, more willing than most of us to give up a great deal of the former in order to secure the latter.

As we have with earlier thinkers, let us see how Hobbes applies this theory of justice, as a prelude to evaluating it critically.  He compares the laws of civil society to “artificial chains” binding us to obey the sovereign authority of the state in the name of justice.  The third law of nature, the law of justice, obliges us to obey the “positive” laws of the state.  Any deliberate violation of civil law is a “crime.”  Now the social problem to be considered is that of criminal punishment.  This deliberately inflicts some sort of “evil” on an alleged criminal for violating civil law.  Its rationale is to enforce obedience to the law itself and, thus, to promote security and public order.  Hobbes lays down various conditions that must be met in order for such an infliction of evil to qualify as legitimate “punishment,” including that no retroactive punishment is justifiable.  He also analyzes five sorts of criminal punishment—“corporal, or pecuniary, or ignominy, or imprisonment, or exile,” allowing for a combination of them; he also specifies that the corporal sort can be capital punishment.  It would be wrong for the state deliberately to punish a member of civil society believed to be innocent; indeed, strictly speaking, it would not even qualify as “punishment,” as it fails to meet an essential part of the definition.  The severity of punishment should be relative to the severity of the crime involved, since its rationale is to deter future violations of civil law (Leviathan, pp. 138, 173, 175, 185, 190, 203-208, 230; see, also, Elements, pp. 177-182, and Citizen, pp. 271-279; near the end of his verse autobiography—Elements, p. 264—Hobbes writes, “Justice I Teach, and Justice Reverence”).

While this is a decent consequentialist theory of crime and punishment, the more general view of justice from which it is derived is far more problematic.  It does stand in sharp contrast to the theories of Plato, Aristotle, Augustine, and Aquinas.  It does revive something like the Sophist theory to which they were all advocating alternatives.  And it does reflect the naturalistic approach represented by the new science.  However, all the foundational elements supporting it are quite dubious:  the radical empiricism, the materialism, the determinism, the egoism, the moral relativism, and the narrow conception of human reason.  Without these props, this theory of justice as artificially constructed by us and purely a function of our interpersonal agreements seems entirely arbitrary.  But in addition to its being insufficiently justified, this theory of justice would justify too much.  For example, what would prevent its involving a justification of slavery, if the alternative for the slaves were death as enemies in a state of nature?  Even apart from the issue of slavery, in the absence of any substantive human rights, minorities in civil society might be denied any set of civil liberties, such as the right to adopt religious practices to which they feel called in conscience.  Hobbes’s conception of justice is reductionistic, reducing it to conventional agreements that seem skewed to sacrifice too much liberty on the altar of law and order.

b. Hume

As a transition between Hobbes and Hume, brief mention can be made of John Locke, the most important political philosopher between them.  (The reason he is not being considered at length here is that he does not offer a distinctive general theory of justice.)  In his masterful Second Treatise of Government, Locke describes a state of nature governed by God’s law but insecure in that there is no mechanism for enforcing it, when the natural rights of property—comprising one’s life, liberty, and estates—are violated.  In order to protect such property rights, people agree to a social contract that moves them from that state of nature to a state of political society, with government established to enforce the law.  Another great social contract theorist between Hobbes and Hume who is worth mentioning here (again he gives us no distinctive theory of justice) is Jean-Jacques Rousseau.  In The Social Contract, he maintains that, in a well-ordered society, the general will (rather than the will of any individual or group of individuals) must prevail.  True freedom in society requires following the general will, and those who do not choose to do so can legitimately be forced to do so.  A human being is allegedly so transformed by the move from the state of nature to that of civil society as to become capable of such genuine freedom as will allow each citizen to consent to all the laws out of deference to the common good.   David Hume, an eighteenth-century Scottish thinker, who is very influenced by Locke’s focus on property while rejecting the social contract theory of Hobbes, Locke, and Rousseau, is an interesting philosopher to consider in relation to Hobbes.  Like Hobbes, Hume is a radical empiricist and a determinist who is skeptical of justice as an objective, absolute virtue.  But Hume does not explicitly embrace materialism, is not a psychological or ethical egoist, and famously attacks the social contract theory’s account of moral and political obligation on both historical grounds (there is no evidence for it, and history shows that force rather than consent has been the basis of government) and philosophical grounds (even if our ancestors had given their consent, that would not be binding on us, and utility is a more plausible explanation of submission than genuine agreement) alike (Essays, pp. 186-201).  In the third section of his Enquiry concerning the Principles of Morals, Hume argues that “public utility is the sole origin of justice.”  To place that claim in context, we can note that, like Hobbes, Hume sees all values, including that of justice, as derived from our passions rather than (as Plato, Aristotle, Augustine, and Aquinas thought) from reason.  Any virtue, he maintains, is desirable in that it provides us with the pleasant feeling of approval; and any vice, including that of injustice, is undesirable in that it provides us with the painful sense of disapproval.  In order to qualify as a virtue, a quality must be “useful or agreeable to the person himself or to others.”  It is possible for some virtues to be rich enough to fit appropriately in more than one of these four categories (for example, benevolence seems to be useful and agreeable to both the benevolent person and to others); but justice is purportedly a virtue only because it is useful to others, as members of society.  Hume offers us a unique and fascinating argument to prove his point.  He imagines four hypothetical scenarios, in which either human nature would be radically different (utterly altruistic or brutally selfish) or our environment would be so (with everything we desire constantly and abundantly available or so destitute that hardly anyone could survive), allegedly showing that, in each of them, justice would not be a virtue at all.  His conclusion is that justice is only a virtue because, relative to reality, which is intermediate among these extremes, it is beneficial to us as members of society.  He also refuses to identify justice with “perfect equality,” maintaining that the ideal of egalitarianism is both “impracticable” and “extremely pernicious to human society.”  For Hume, the rules of justice essentially involve protecting private property, although property rights are not absolute and may be abridged in extreme cases where “public safety” and the common good require it.  Even international relations normally require that “rules of justice” be observed for mutual advantage, although public utility can also require that they should be suspended (Enquiry, pp. 20, 85, 72, 21-25, 28-35; see also Essays, pp. 20, 202).  Though different from Hobbes’s theory, this one also leans towards the Sophist view of justice as conventional and relative.

In his masterpiece, A Treatise of Human Nature, Hume makes the striking claim, “Reason is, and ought only to be the slave of the passions,” which rules out all forms of ethical rationalism.  He also makes a remarkable distinction between descriptive language regarding what “is, and is not,” on the one hand, and prescriptive language concerning what “ought, or ought not” to be, on the other, challenging the possibility of ever justifying value claims by means of any factual ones, of logically inferring what should be from what is.  The second part of Book 3 of Hume’s Treatise deals extensively with justice.  Here he calls it an “artificial” but “not arbitrary” virtue, in that we construct it as a virtue for our own purposes, relative to our needs and circumstances, as we experience them.  It is valuable as a means to the end of social cooperation, which is mutually “advantageous.”   An especially beneficial, if unnatural, convention is respecting others’ property, which is what the rules of justice essentially require of us.  The psychological grounds of our sense of justice are a combination of “self-interest” and “sympathy” for others.  He holds a very conservative view of property rights, in that, normally, people should be allowed to keep what they already have acquired.  Indeed, justice normally comprises three principles—“of the stability of possession, of its transference by consent, and of the performance of promises.”  He rejects the traditional definition of justice as giving others their due, because it rashly and wrongly assumes that “right and property” have prior objective reality independent of conventions of justice.  Internationally, the rules of justice assume the status of “the law of nations,” obliging civilized governments to respect the ambassadors of other countries, to declare war prior to engaging them in battle, to refrain from using poisonous weapons against them, and so forth.  The rationale for such principles of international justice is that they reduce the horrors of war and facilitate the advantages of peace.  By respecting other societies’ possessions, leaders minimize the likelihood of war; by respecting the transference of possessions by mutual consent, they enhance the possibilities of international trade; and by keeping their promises, they create a climate for peaceful alliances.  A bit later, Hume adopts a position which, in the twentieth century, has been called a “rule utilitarian” view of justice, writing that, though individual acts of justice might be contrary to public utility, they ought to be performed if they are conducive to “a general scheme or system” of conduct that benefits society as a whole (Treatise, pp. 266, 302, 311, 307, 312, 315, 320-321, 323, 337-338, 362-363, 370-371).  Yet the rules of justice that are normally conducive to public utility are never absolute and can be legitimately contravened where following them would seem to do more harm than good to our society.  He applies this view to the issue of civil disobedience, which is normally unjust because it threatens “public utility” but can be justified as a last resort “in extraordinary circumstances” when that same public utility is in jeopardy (Essays, pp. 202-204).  Whether that is or is not the case in specific circumstances becomes a judgment call.

Hume is important here because of a convergence of several factors.  First, like the Sophists and Hobbes, he makes justice a social construct that is relative to human needs and interests.  Second, like Hobbes, he associates it fundamentally with human passions rather than with reason.  Third, the virtue of justice and the rules of justice are essentially connected to the protection of private property.  And, fourth, he considers public utility to be the sole basis of justice.  This theory would prove extremely influential, in that Kant will take issue with it, while utilitarians like Mill will build on its flexibility.  This sort of flexibility is both a strength and a weakness of Hume’s theory of justice.  While it may be attractive to allow for exceptions to the rules, this also creates a kind of instability.  Is justice merely an instrumental good, having no intrinsic value?  If that were the case, then it would make sense to say that the role of reason is simply to calculate the most effective means to our most desirable ends.  But then, assuming that our ends were sufficiently desirable, any means necessary to achieve them would presumably be justifiable—so that, morally and politically, anything goes, in principle, regardless how revolting.  Finally, notice that Hume himself, because of the empirical nature of his practical philosophy, fails to avoid the “is-ought” trap against which he so deftly warned us:  because some end is sufficiently desired, whatever means are necessary, or even most effective, to achieve it ought to be pursued.  Is this the best we can do in our pursuit of an adequate theory of justice?

4. Recent Modernity

Moving from one of the greatest philosophers of the Enlightenment to the other, we shall see that Kant will take more seriously the “is-ought” challenge than Hume himself did.  As justice is both a moral and a political virtue, helping to prescribe both a good character and right conduct, the question of how such obligations arise is crucial.  For Hume, we ought to pursue virtue (including justice) because it (allegedly) is agreeable and/or useful to do so.  But, then, what is the logical link here?  Why should we, morally speaking, act for the sake of agreeableness and utility?  For Kant, the reason we should choose to do what is right has nothing to do with good consequences.  It is merely because it is the right thing to do.  Conceding that prescriptive “ought” claims can never be logically deduced from any set of factually descriptive “is” claims, Kant will forsake the empirical approach to justice (of Hobbes and Hume) in favor of the sort of rationalistic one that will revert to seeing it as an absolute value, not to be compromised, regardless of circumstances and likely consequences.  Then we shall consider the utilitarian response to this, as developed by the philosopher who is, arguably, the greatest consequentialist of modern times, John Stuart Mill, who, as an empiricist, like Hobbes and Hume, will make what is right a function of what is good.

a. Kant

Immanuel Kant, an eighteenth-century German professor from East Prussia, found his rationalistic philosophical convictions profoundly challenged by Hume’s formidable skepticism (as well as being fascinated by the ideas of Rousseau).  Even though he was not convinced by it, Kant was sufficiently disturbed by it that he committed decades to trying to answer it, creating a revolutionary new philosophical system in order to do so.  This system includes, but is far from limited to, a vast, extensive practical philosophy, comprising many books and essays, including a theory of justice.  It is well known that this practical philosophy—including both his ethical theory and socio-political philosophy—is the most renowned example of deontology (from the Greek, meaning the study or science of duty).  Whereas teleological or consequentialist theories (such as those of Hobbes and Hume) see what is right as a function of and relative to good ends, a deontological theory such as Kant’s sees what is right as independent of what we conceive to be good and, thus, as potentially absolute.  Justice categorically requires a respect for the right, regardless of inconvenient or uncomfortable circumstances and regardless of desirable and undesirable consequences.  Because of the “is-ought” problem, the best way to proceed is to avoid the empirical approach that is necessarily committed to trying to derive obligations from alleged facts.

This is precisely Kant’s approach in the foundational book of his system of practical philosophy, his Grounding for the Metaphysics of Morals.  He argues, in its Preface, that, since the moral law “must carry with it absolute necessity” and since empiricism only yields “contingent and uncertain” results, we must proceed by way of “pure practical reason, “ which would be, to the extent possible, “purified of everything empirical,” such as physiological, psychological, and environmental contingencies.  On this view, matters of right will be equally applicable to all persons as potentially autonomous rational agents, regardless of any contingent differences, of gender, racial or ethnic identity, socio-economic class status, and so forth.  If Kant can pull this off, it will take him further in the direction of equality of rights than any previous philosopher considered here.  In order to establish a concept of right that is independent of empirical needs, desires, and interests, Kant argues for a single fundamental principle of all duty, which he calls the “categorical imperative,” because it tells us what, as persons, we ought to do, unconditionally.  It is a test we can use to help us rationally to distinguish between right and wrong; and he offers three different formulations of it which he considers three different ways of saying the same thing:  (a) the first is a formula of universalizability, that we should try to do only what we could reasonably will should become a universal law; (b) the second is a formula of respect for all persons, that we should try always to act in such a way as to respect all persons, ourselves and all others, as intrinsically valuable “ends in themselves” and never treat any persons merely as instrumental means to other ends; and (c) the third is a “principle of autonomy,” that we, as morally autonomous rational agents, should try to act in such a way that we could be reasonably legislating for a (hypothetical) moral republic of all persons.  For the dignity of all persons, rendering them intrinsically valuable and worthy of respect, is a function of their capacity for moral autonomy.  In his Metaphysics of Morals, Kant develops his ethical system, beyond this foundation, into a doctrine of right and a doctrine of virtue.  The former comprises strict duties of justice, while the latter comprises broader duties of merit.  Obviously, it is the former category, duties we owe all other persons, regardless of circumstances and consequences, that concerns us here, justice being a matter of strict right rather than one of meritorious virtue.  At the very end of his Metaphysics of Morals, Kant briefly discusses “divine justice,” whereby God legitimately punishes people for violating their duties (Ethical, pp. 2-3, 30-44, 36, 48, 158-161).

In his Metaphysical Elements of Justice, which constitutes the first part of his Metaphysics of Morals, Kant develops his theory of justice.  (His concept of Rechtslehre—literally, “doctrine of right”—has also been translated as “doctrine of justice” and “doctrine of law.”)  For Kant, justice is inextricably bound up with obligations with which we can rightly be required to comply. To say that we have duties of justice to other persons is to indicate that they have rights, against us, that we should perform those duties—so that duties of justice and rights are correlative.  Three conditions must be met in order that the concept of justice should apply:  (a) we must be dealing with external interpersonal behaviors; (b) it must relate to willed action and not merely to wishes, desires, and needs; and (c) the consequences intended are not morally relevant.  A person is not committing an injustice by considering stealing another’s property or in wanting to do so, but only by voluntarily taking action to appropriate it without permission; and the act is not justified no matter what good consequences may be intended.  According to Kant, there is only one innate human right possessed by all persons; that is the right freely to do what one wills, so long as that is “compatible with the freedom of everyone else in accordance with a universal law.”  Thus one person’s right freely to act cannot extend to infringing on the freedom of others or the violation of their rights.  This leads to Kant’s ultimate universal principle of justice, which is itself a categorical imperative:  “Every action is just [right] that in itself or in its maxim is such that the freedom of the will of each can coexist together with the freedom of everyone in accordance with a universal law.”  Although the use of coercive force against other persons involves an attempt to restrict their freedom, this is not necessarily unjust, if it is used to counteract their unjust abuse of freedom—for example, in self-defense or punishment or even war.  Kant approvingly invokes three ancient rules of justice:  (1) we should be honest in our dealings with others; (2) we should avoid being unjust towards others even if that requires our trying to avoid them altogether; and (3) if we cannot avoid associating with others, we should at least try to respect their rights (Justice, pp. 29, 38, 30-31, 37; see also Lectures, pp. 211-212).

Kant distinguishes between natural or private justice, on the one hand, and civil or public justice, on the other.  He has an intricate theory of property rights, which we can only touch upon here.  We can claim, in the name of justice, to have rights to (a) physical property, such as your car, (b) the performance of a particular deed by another person, such as the auto shop keeping its agreement to try to fix your car, and (c) certain characteristics of interpersonal relationships with those under our authority, such as obedient children and respectful servants.  Someone who steals your car or the auto mechanic who has agreed to fix it and then fails to try to do so is doing you an injustice.  Children, as developing but dependent persons, have a right to support and care from their parents; but, in turn, they owe their parents obedience while under their authority.  Children are not the property of their parents and must never be treated like things or objects; and, when they have become independent of their parents, they owe them nothing more than gratitude.  Similarly, a master must respect a servant as a person.  The servant may be under contract to serve the master, but that contract cannot be permanent or legitimately involve the giving up of the servant’s personhood (in other words, one cannot justifiably enter into slavery).  While the master has authority over the servant, that must never be viewed as ownership or involve abuse.  This all concerns private or natural justice, having to do with the securing of property rights.  Next let us next consider how Kant applies his theory of justice to the problem of crime and punishment, in the area of public or civil justice, involving protective, commutative, and distributive justice, the requirements of which can be legitimately enforced by civil society.  When a person commits a crime, that involves misusing freedom to infringe the freedom of others or to violate their rights.  Thus the criminal forfeits the right to freedom and can become a legitimate prisoner of the state.  Kant considers the rule that criminals should be punished for their crimes to be “a categorical imperative,” a matter of just “retribution” not to be denied or even mitigated for utilitarian reasons.  This extends to the ultimate punishment, the death penalty:  justice requires that murderers, the most heinous criminals, should suffer capital punishment, as no lesser penalty would be just.  A third application to consider here is that of war.  This is in the international part of public justice that Kant calls “the Law of Nations.”  He adopts a non-empirical version of the social contract theory, interpreting it not as a historical fact mysteriously generating obligations but rather as a hypothetical idea of what free and equal moral agents could reasonably agree to in the way of rules of justice.  Unlike Hobbes, he does not see this as a basis for all moral duty.  It does account for the obligation we have to the state and other citizens.  But states have duties to other states, so that there is an international law of nations.  Even though different states, in the absence of international law, are in a natural condition of a state of war, as Hobbes thought, he was wrong to think that, in that state, anything rightly goes and that there is no justice.  War is bad, and we should try to minimize the need for it, although Kant is not a pacifist and can justify it for purposes of self-defense.  Kant proposes an international “league of nations” to help provide for mutual “protection against external aggression” and, thus, to discourage it and reduce the need to go to war.  Still, when war cannot be avoided, it should be declared rather than launched by means of a sneak attack; secondly, there are legitimate limits that prohibit, for example, trying to exterminate or subjugate all members of the enemy society; third, when a war is over, the winning party cannot destroy the civil freedom of the losing parties, as by enslaving them; and, fourth, certain “rights of peace” must be assured and honored for all involved.  Thus the ultimate goal of international relations and of the league of nations should be the ideal of “perpetual peace” among different states that share our planet (Justice, pp. 41, 43, 91-95, 113, 136-141, 146, 151-158; for more on Kant’s version of the social contract theory, see Writings, pp. 73-85, and for more on his views on war and “perpetual peace,” see Writings, pp. 93-130).  Thus we see Kant applying his own theory of justice in three areas:  in the area of private law having to do with the securing of property rights, in the area of public law having to do with retributive punishment for crimes committed, and in the area of international justice concerned with war and peace.

What shall we critically say about this theory?  First, it argues for a sense of justice in terms of objective, non-arbitrary right—against, say, Hobbes and Hume.  Second, this sense of justice is of a piece with Kant’s categorical imperative, in that the rules of justice (e.g., regarding property rights, punishment, and war) are universalizable, designed to respect persons as intrinsically valuable, and conforming to the principle of autonomy.  Third, if Hume is correct in suggesting that we can never logically infer what ought to be from what actually is, then Kant’s is the only theory we have considered thus far that can pass the test.  To focus the issue, ask the question, why should we be just?  For Plato, this is the way to achieve the fulfillment of a well-ordered soul.  For Aristotle, the achievement and exercising of moral virtue is a necessary condition of human flourishing.  For Augustine and Aquinas, God’s eternal law requires that we, as God’s personal creatures, should be just, with our salvation at stake.  For Hobbes, practicing justice is required by enlightened self-interest.  For Hume, even though our being just may not benefit us directly all the time, it is conducive to public utility or the good of the society of which we are members.  But for each of these claims, we can ask, so what?  If any combination of these claims were to turn out to be correct, we could still legitimately ask why we should therefore be just.  Are we to assume that we ought to do whatever it takes to achieve a well-ordered soul or to flourish or to comply with God’s will or to serve our own self-interest or public utility?  Why?  Consider Kant’s answer:  we should try to be just because it’s the right thing to do and because it is our duty, as rational, moral agents, to try to do what is right.  Kant’s analysis of justice works well; and, given that, his applications to property rights, crime and punishment, and war and peace are also impressive.  Yet his theory is commonly rejected as too idealistic to be realistically applicable in the so-called “real world,” because it maintains that some things can be absolutely unjust and are, thus, categorically impermissible, regardless of likely consequences.  His theory as we have considered it here is a paradigmatic example of the view of justice being advocated in this article, as essentially requiring respect for persons as free, rational agents.  Yet Kant’s inflexibility in other points of application, such as in his absolute prohibition against lying to a would-be murderer in order to save innocent human life (Ethical, pp. 162-166), his idea that women and servants are merely “passive citizens” unfit to vote, and his categorical denial of any right to resistance or revolution against oppression (Justice, pp. 120, 124-128), is problematic here, inviting an alternative such as is represented by Mill’s utilitarianism.

b. Mill

Let us consider a bit of Karl Marx (and his collaborator Friedrich Engels) as a quick transition between Kant and Mill.  Kant represents the very sort of bourgeois conception of justice against which Marx and Engels protest in their call, in The Communist Manifesto, for a socialistic revolution.  Marx explains the ideal of socio-economic equality he advocates with the famous slogan that all should be required to contribute to society to the extent of their abilities and all should be allowed to receive from society in accordance with their needs.  John Stuart Mill, a nineteenth-century English philosopher, was aware of the call for a Communist revolution and advocated progressive liberal reform as an alternative path to political evolution.  Whereas Kant was the first great deontologist, Mill subscribed to the already established tradition of utilitarianism.  Although earlier British thinkers (including Hobbes and Hume) were proto-utilitarians, incorporating elements of the theory into their own worldviews, the movement, as such, is usually thought to stem from the publication of Jeremy Bentham’s Introduction to the Principles of Morals and Legislation in 1789.  He there proposes the “principle of utility,” which he also later calls the “greatest happiness” principle, as the desirable basis for individual and collective decision-making:  “By the principle of utility is meant that principle which approves or disapproves of every action whatsoever, according to the tendency which it appears to have to augment or diminish the happiness of the party whose interest is in question.”  That single sentence establishes the ultimate criterion for utilitarian reasoning and the root of a great movement.  A famous lawyer named John Austin, under whom Mill studied, wrote a book of jurisprudence based on Bentham’s “principle of general utility.”  Mill’s father, James Mill, was a friend and disciple of Bentham and educated his only son also to be a utilitarian.  Near the end of his life, Mill observed that it was the closest thing to a religion in which his father raised him.  And, if he was not the founder of this secular religion, he clearly became its most effective evangelist.  In Utilitarianism, his own great essay in ethical theory, Mill gives his own statement of the principle of utility (again employing a curiously religious word):  “The creed which accepts as the foundation of morals, Utility, or the Greatest Happiness Principle, holds that actions are right in proportion as they tend to promote happiness, wrong as they tend to produce the reverse of happiness.”  He immediately proceeds to interpret human happiness and unhappiness (as Bentham had done) in hedonistic terms of pleasure and pain (Utilitarianism, pp. 33-34, 329, 257).  This presents the deceptive appearance of a remarkably simple rubric for practical judgment:  if an action generates an excess of pleasure over pain, that contributes to human happiness, which is our greatest good, making the action right; on the other hand, if an action generates an excess of pain over pleasure, that contributes to human unhappiness, which is our greatest evil, making the action wrong.  But what is deceptive about this is the notion that we can sufficiently anticipate future consequences to be able to predict where our actions will lead us.  (Notice, also, that unlike Kantian deontology, which makes what is right independent of good consequences, utilitarianism makes the former a function of the latter.)

Mill acknowledges that concern about a possible conflict between utility and justice has always been “one of the strongest obstacles” to the acceptance of utilitarianism.  If permanently enslaving a minority could produce overwhelming happiness for a majority (he was personally opposed to slavery as an unconscionable violation of human liberty), then, given that utility is the value that trumps all others, why shouldn’t the injustice of slavery be accepted as a (regrettably) necessary means to a socially desirable end, the former, however unfortunate, being thus justified?  Mill thinks that the key to solving this alleged problem is that of conceptual analysis, that if we properly understand what “utility” and “justice” are all about, we shall be able to see that no genuine conflict between them is possible.  We have already discerned what the former concept means and now need to elucidate the latter.  Mill lays out five dimensions of justice as we use the term:  (1) respecting others’ “legal rights” is considered just, while violating them is unjust; (2) respecting the “moral right” someone has to something is just, while violating it is unjust; (3) it is considered just to give a person what “he deserves” and unjust to deny it; (4) it is thought unjust to “break faith” with another, while keeping faith with others is just; and (5) in some circumstances, it is deemed unjust “to be partial” in one’s judgments and just to be impartial.  People commonly associate all of these with justice, and they do seem to represent legitimate aspects of the virtue.  (Interestingly, Mill rejects the idea “of equality” as essential to our understanding of justice, a stand which would be problematic for Marxists.)  As he seeks his own common denominator for these various dimensions of justice, he observes that justice always goes beyond generic right and wrong to involve what “some individual person can claim from us as his moral right.”  This entails the legitimate sense that anyone who has committed an injustice deserves to be punished somehow (which connects with Kant).  Mill thinks all this boils down to the idea that justice is a term “for certain moral requirements, which, regarded collectively, stand higher in the scale of social utility,” being more obligatory “than any others.”  But this means that justice, properly understood, is a name for the most important of “social utilities” (ibid., pp. 296-301, 305, 309, 320-321).  Therefore there purportedly cannot be any genuine conflict between utility and justice.  If there ever were circumstances in which slavery were truly useful to humanity, then presumably it would be just; the reason it is (typically) unjust is that it violates utility.  The main goal here is to reduce justice to social utility, in such a way as to rule out, by definition, any ultimate conflict between the two.  Thus, the social role played by our sense of justice is allegedly that it serves the common good.

Mill’s other great work is On Liberty, which provides us with a connecting link between this utilitarian theory and applications of it to particular social issues.  The problem Mill sets for himself here is where to draw a reasonable line between areas in which society can rightly proscribe behavior and those in which people should be allowed the freedom to do as they will.  When is it just to interfere with a person’s acting on personal choice?  To solve this problem, which is as relevant today as it was a century and a half ago, he proposes his “one very simple principle” of liberty, which he states in two slightly different ways:  (1) the “self-protection” version holds that people can only legitimately interfere with the freedom of action of others to protect themselves from them; (2) the “harm” version maintains that force can only be justifiably used against other members of community to prevent their harming others.  It is not acceptable to use power against others to stop them from hurting only themselves.  Mill candidly admits that this principle is reasonably feasible only with regard to mature, responsible members of civilized societies—not to children or to the insane or even necessarily to primitive peoples who cannot make informed judgments about their own true good.  He decisively renounces any appeal to abstract rights as a basis for this principle, basing it simply on “utility in the largest sense, grounded on the permanent interests of a man as a progressive being.”  Notice that this presupposes that we can distinguish between other-regarding behavior, which may be justifiably regulated, and purely self-regarding behavior, which may not be.  If that turns out to be a false distinction, then Mill’s theory may collapse.  At any rate, he articulates at least three areas of social life in which people’s liberty should be “absolute and unqualified”:  (a) that of freedom of thought and expression; (b) that of freedom of personal lifestyle; and (c) the freedom to associate with others of one’s choice, so long as it is for peaceful purposes.  He seems confident that utility will always require that freedom be protected in these areas (ibid., pp. 135-138).  In other words, on this liberal utilitarian view, it would always be unjust for an individual or a social group, in a civilized society, deliberately to interfere with a responsible, rational person’s actions in any combination of these areas.

Let us now see how Mill applies his utilitarian theory to three problems of justice that are still timely today.  First of all, the issue of punishment is one he considers in Utilitarianism, though his discussion is aimed at considering alternative accounts rather than conclusively saying what he himself thinks (we might also observe that, in this short passage, he attacks the social contract theory as a useless fiction) (ibid., pp. 311-313).  As a utilitarian, he favors the judicious use of punishment in order to deter criminal activity.  He believes in the utility/justice of self-defense and sees the right to punish as anchored in that.  In 1868, as an elected member of Parliament, he made a famous speech in the House of Commons supporting capital punishment on utilitarian grounds.  Although it is clear that he would like to be able to support a bill for its abolition, the lawful order of society, a necessary condition of societal well-being, requires this means of deterring the most heinous crimes, such as aggravated murder.  He even thinks it a quicker, more humane punishment than incarcerating someone behind bars for the rest of his life.  Mill does worry about the possibility of executing an innocent person, but he thinks a carefully managed legal system can render this danger “extremely rare” (“Punishment,” pp. 266-272).  Thus his utilitarian theory provides him with a basis for supporting capital punishment as morally justifiable.  A second famous application of his utilitarian theory of justice Mill makes is to the issue of equal opportunity for women.  In the very first paragraph of The Subjection of Women, Mill maintains that “the principle which regulates the existing social relations between the two sexes—the legal subordination of one sex to the other—is wrong in itself, and now one of the chief hindrances to human improvement; and that it ought to be replaced by a principle of perfect equality, admitting no power or privilege on the one side, nor disability on the other.”  So he does not call for the preferential treatment of “affirmative action” but only for equal opportunity.  Unlike contemporary feminists, he does not appeal to women’s human rights as his rationale, but only to the maximization of “human happiness” and the liberty “that makes life valuable” (Subjection, pp. 1, 26, 101).  Here, again, we have an issue of social justice to which his utilitarian theory is applied, generating liberal conclusions.  Our third issue of application is that of international non-intervention.  Mill’s general principle here is that using force against others is prima facie unjust. Although defensive wars can be justifiable, aggressive ones are not.  It can be justifiable to go to war without being attacked or directly threatened with an attack, for example, to help civilize a barbarian society, which, as such, allegedly has no rights.  It can be justifiable to save a subjected population from the oppression of a despotic government (“Non-Intervention,” pp. 376-383).  All of this is presumably a function of utilitarian welfare.  Once more, a still timely moral issue has been addressed using the utilitarian theory of justice.

These applications all plausibly utilize the values and reasoning of utilitarianism, which, by its very nature, must be consequentialist.  From that perspective, the deterrence approach to punishment, including capital punishment, seems appropriate, as do Mill’s call for equal opportunity for women and his measured position on international interventionism.  Surely, the premium he places on human happiness is admirable, as is his universal perspective, which views all humans as counting.  The problem is in his assumptions that all values are relative to consequences, that human happiness is the ultimate good, and that this reduces to the maximization of pleasure and the minimization of pain.  The upshot of this position is that, in principle, nothing can  be categorically forbidden, that, given sufficiently desirable ends, any means necessary to achieve them can be justified.  If we really believe that there can be no genuine conflict between justice and utility because the former is merely the most important part of the latter, then the rules of justice are reducible to calculations regarding what is generally conducive to the greatest happiness for the greatest number of people—mere inductive generalizations which must permit of exceptions; at least Mill’s ambiguity leaves him open to this interpretation.  There would seem to be a tension in Mill’s thought:  on the one hand, he wants to respect the liberty of all (civilized) responsible persons as rational agents; but, on the other hand, his commitment to utilitarianism would seem to subordinate that respect to the greatest good for the greatest number of people, allowing for the possibility of sacrificing the interests of the few to those of the many.

5. Contemporary Philosophers

From its founding, American political thought had an enduring focus on justice.  The Preamble to the American Constitution says that one of its primary goals is to “establish justice.”  Founding father James Madison, in 1788, wrote in The Federalist Papers that justice should be the goal of all government and of all civil society, that people are willing to risk even liberty in its pursuit.  American schoolchildren are made to memorize and recite a Pledge of Allegiance that ends with the words “with liberty and justice for all.”  So justice is an abiding American ideal.  We shall now consider how one of America’s greatest philosophers, John Rawls, addresses this ideal.  We should notice how he places a greater emphasis on equality than do most of his European predecessors—perhaps reflecting the conviction of the American Declaration of Independence that “all men are created equal.”  (This greater emphasis may reflect the influence of Marx, whom he occasionally mentions.)  After considering the formidable contributions of Rawls to justice theory and some of its applications, we shall conclude this survey with a brief treatment of several post-Rawlsian alternatives.  A key focus that will distinguish this section from previous ones is the effort to achieve a conception of justice that strikes a reasonable balance between liberty and equality.

a. Rawls

Rawls burst into prominence in 1958 with the publication of his game-changing paper, “Justice as Fairness.”  Though it was not his first important publication, it revived the social contract theory that had been languishing in the wake of Hume’s critique and its denigration by utilitarians and pragmatists, though it was a Kantian version of it that Rawls advocated.  This led to a greatly developed book version, A Theory of Justice, published in 1971, arguably the most important book of American philosophy published in the second half of the last century.  Rawls makes it clear that his theory, which he calls “justice as fairness,” assumes a Kantian view of persons as “free and equal,” morally autonomous, rational agents, who are not necessarily egoists.  He also makes it clear early on that he means to present his theory as a preferable alternative to that of utilitarians.  He asks us to imagine persons in a hypothetical “initial situation” which he calls “the original position” (corresponding to the “state of nature” or “natural condition” of Hobbes, but clearly not presented as any sort of historical or pre-historical fact).  This is strikingly characterized by what Rawls calls “the veil of ignorance,” a device designed to minimize the influence of selfish bias in attempting to determine what would be just.  If you must decide on what sort of society you could commit yourself to accepting as a permanent member and were not allowed to factor in specific knowledge about yourself—such as your gender, race, ethnic identity, level of intelligence, physical strength, quickness and stamina, and so forth—then you would presumably exercise the rational choice to make the society as fair for everyone as possible, lest you find yourself at the bottom of that society for the rest of your life.  In such a “purely hypothetical” situation, Rawls believes that we would rationally adopt two basic principles of justice for our society:  “the first requires equality in the assignment of basic rights and duties, while the second holds that social and economic inequalities, for example inequalities of wealth and authority, are just only if they result in compensating benefits for everyone, and in particular for the least advantaged members of society.”  Here we see Rawls conceiving of justice, the primary social virtue, as requiring equal basic liberties for all citizens and a presumption of equality even regarding socio-economic goods.  He emphasizes the point that these principles rule out as unjust the utilitarian justification of disadvantages for some on account of greater advantages for others, since that would be rationally unacceptable to one operating under the veil of ignorance.  Like Kant, Rawls is opposed to the teleological or consequentialist gambit of defining the right (including the just) in terms of “maximizing the good”; he rather, like Kant, the deontologist, is committed to a “priority of the right over the good.”  Justice is not reducible to utility or pragmatic desirability.  We should notice that the first principle of justice, which requires maximum equality of rights and duties for all members of society, is prior in “serial or lexical order” to the second, which specifies how socio-economic inequalities can be justified (Theory, pp. 12-26, 31, 42-43).  Again, this is anti-utilitarian, in that no increase in socio-economic benefits for anyone can ever justify anything less than maximum equality of rights and duties for all.  Thus, for example, if enslaving a few members of society generated vastly more benefits for the majority than liabilities for them, such a bargain would be categorically ruled out as unjust.

Rawls proceeds to develop his articulation of these two principles of justice more carefully.  He reformulates the first one in terms of maximum equal liberty, writing that “each person is to have an equal right to the most extensive basic liberty compatible with a similar liberty for others.”  The basic liberties intended concern such civil rights as are protected in our Constitution—free speech, freedom of assembly, freedom of conscience, the right to private property, the rights to vote and hold public office, freedom from arbitrary arrest and seizure, etc.  The lexical priority of this first principle requires that it be categorical in that the only justification for limiting any basic liberties would be to enhance other basic liberties; for example, it might be just to limit free access of the press to a sensational legal proceeding in order to protect the right of the accused to a fair trial.  Rawls restates his second principle to maintain that “social and economic inequalities are to be arranged so that they are both (a) reasonably expected to be to everyone’s advantage, and (b) attached to positions and offices open to all.”  Thus socio-economic inequalities can be justified, but only if both conditions are met.  The first condition (a) is “the difference principle” and takes seriously the idea that every socio-economic difference separating one member of society from others must be beneficial to all, including the person ranked lowest.  The second condition is one of “fair equality of opportunity,” in that socio-economic advantages must be connected to positions to which all members of society could have access.  For example, the office of the presidency has attached to it greater social prestige and income than is available to most of us.  Is that just?  It can be, assuming that all of us, as citizens, could achieve that office with its compensations and that even those of us at or near the bottom of the socio-economic scale benefit from intelligent, talented people accepting the awesome responsibilities of that office.  Just as the first principle must be lexically prior to the second, Rawls also maintains that “fair opportunity is prior to the difference principle.”  Thus, if we have to choose between equal opportunity for all and socio-economically benefiting “the least advantaged” members of society, the former has priority over the latter.  Most of us today might be readily sympathetic to the first principle and the equal opportunity condition, while finding the difference principle to be objectionably egalitarian, to the point of threatening incentives to contribute more than is required.  Rawls does consider a “mixed conception” of justice that most of us would regard as more attractive “arising when the principle of average utility constrained by a certain social minimum is substituted for the difference principle, everything else remaining unchanged.”  But there would be a problem of fairly agreeing on that acceptable social minimum, and it would change with shifting contingent circumstances.  It is curious that his own theory of “justice as fairness” gets attacked by socialists such as Nielsen (whom we shall consider) for sacrificing equality for the sake of liberty and by libertarians such as Nozick (whom we shall also consider) for giving up too much liberty for the sake of equality.  Rawls briefly suggests that his theory of justice as fairness might be applied to international relations, in general, and to just war theory, in particular (ibid., pp. 60-65, 75, 83, 302-303, 316, 378).

Rawls applies his theory of justice to the domestic issue of civil disobedience.  No society is perfectly just.  A generally or “nearly just society” can have unjust laws, in which case its citizens may or may not have a duty to comply with them, depending on how severely unjust they are.  If the severity of the injustice is not great, then respect for democratic majority rule might morally dictate compliance.  Otherwise, citizens can feel a moral obligation to engage in civil disobedience, which Rawls defines as “a public, nonviolent, conscientious yet political act contrary to law usually done with the aim of bringing about a change in the law or policies of the government.”  Certain conditions must be met in order that an act of civil disobedience be justified:  (1) it should normally address violations of equal civil liberties (the first principle of justice) and/or of “fair equality of opportunity” (the second part of the second principle), with violations of the difference principle (the first part of the second principle) being murkier and, thus, harder to justify; (2) the act of civil disobedience should come only after appeals to the political majority have been reasonably tried and failed; (3) it must seem likely to accomplish more good than harm for the social order.  Yet, even if all three of these conditions seem to be met and the disobedient action seems right, there remains the practical question of whether it would be “wise or prudent,” under the circumstances, to engage in the act of civil disobedience.  Ultimately, every individual must decide for himself or herself whether such action is morally and prudentially justifiable or not as reasonably and responsibly as possible.  The acts of civil disobedience of Martin Luther King (to whom Rawls refers in a footnote) seem to have met all the conditions, to have been done in the name of justice, and to have been morally justified (ibid., pp. 350-357, 363-367, 372-376, 389-390, 364n).

Rawls’s second book was Political Liberalism.  Here he works out how a just political conception might develop a workable “overlapping consensus” despite the challenges to social union posed by a pluralism of “reasonable comprehensive doctrines.”  This, of course, calls for some explanation.  A just society must protect basic liberties equally for all of its members, including freedom of thought and its necessary condition, freedom of expression.  But, in a free society that protects these basic liberties, a pluralism of views and values is likely to develop, such that people can seriously disagree about matters they hold dear.  They will develop their own “comprehensive doctrines,” or systems of beliefs that may govern all significant aspects of their lives.  These may be religious (like Christianity) or philosophical (like Kantianism) or moral (like utilitarian).  Yet a variety of potentially conflicting comprehensive doctrines may be such that all are reasonable.  In such a case, social unity requires respect for and tolerance of other sets of beliefs.  It would be unjust deliberately to suppress reasonable comprehensive doctrines merely because they are different from our own.  The problem of political liberalism nowadays is how we can establish “a stable and just society whose free and equal citizens are deeply divided by conflicting and even incommensurable religious, philosophical, and moral doctrines.”  What is needed is a shared “political conception of justice” that is neutral regarding competing comprehensive doctrines.  This could allow for “an overlapping consensus of reasonable comprehensive doctrines,” such that tolerance and mutual respect are operative even among those committed to incompatible views and values, so long as they are reasonable (Liberalism, pp. 291-292, 340-342, 145, xviii, 13, 152n., 59-60, 133, 154-155, 144, 134).  Thus, for example, a Christian Kantian and an atheistic utilitarian, while sincerely disagreeing on many ethical principles, philosophical ideas, and religious beliefs, can unite in mutually accepting, for instance, the American Constitution as properly binding on all of us equally.  This agreement will enable them mutually to participate in social cooperation, the terms of which are fair and reciprocal and which can contribute to the reasonable good of the entire society.

Near the end of his life, Rawls published The Law of Peoples, in which he tried to apply his theory of justice to international relations.  Given that not all societies act justly and that societies have a right to defend themselves against aggressive violent force, there can be a right to go to war (jus ad bellum).  Yet even then, not all is fair in war, and rules of just warfare (jus in bello) should be observed:  (1) the goal must be a “just and lasting peace”; (2) it must be waged in defense of freedom and security from aggression; (3) reasonable attempts must be made not to attack innocent non-combatants; (4) the human rights of enemies (for example, against being tortured) must be respected; (5) attempts should be made to establish peaceful relations; and (6) practical tactics must always remain within the parameters of moral principles.  After hostilities have ceased, just conquerors must treat their conquered former enemies with respect—not, for example, enslaving them or denying them civil liberties.  Rawls adds a very controversial “supreme emergency exemption” in relation to the third rule—when a relatively just society’s very survival is in desperate peril, its attacking enemy civilian populations, as by bombing cities, can be justifiable.  More generally, Rawls applies his theory of justice to international relations, generating eight rules regarding how the people of other societies must be treated.  While we do not have time to explore them all here, the last one is sufficiently provocative to be worth our considering:  “Peoples have a duty to assist other peoples living under unfavorable conditions that prevent their having a just or decent political and social regime.”  This, of course, goes beyond not exploiting, cheating, manipulating, deceiving, and interfering with others to a positive duty of trying to help them, at the cost of time, money, and other resources.  Justice demands that we try to assist what Rawls calls “burdened societies,” so that doing so is not morally supererogatory.  What is most interesting here is what Rawls refuses to say.  While different peoples, internationally speaking, might be imagined in an original position under the veil of ignorance, and Rawls would favor encouraging equal liberties and opportunities for all, he refuses to apply the difference principle globally in such a way as to indicate that justice requires a massive redistribution of wealth from richer to poorer societies (Peoples, pp. 94-96, 98-99, 37, 106, 114-117).

From a critical perspective, Rawls’s theory of civil disobedience is excellent, as are his theory of political liberalism and his version of the just war theory, except for that “supreme emergency exemption,” which uncharacteristically tries to make right a function of teleological good.  His views on international aid seem so well worked out that, ironically, they call into question part of his general theory of justice itself.  It does not seem plausible that the difference principle should apply intrasocietally but not internationally.  The problem may be with the difference principle itself.  It is not at all clear that rational agents in a hypothetical original position would adopt such an egalitarian principle.  The veil of ignorance leading to this controversial principle can itself be questioned as artificial and unrealistic; one might object that, far from being methodologically neutral, it sets up a bias (towards, for example, being risk-aversive) that renders Rawls’s own favored principles of justice almost a foregone conclusion.  Indeed, the “mixed conception” that Rawls himself considers and rejects seems more plausible and more universally applicable—keeping the first principle and the second part of the second but replacing the difference principle with one of average utility, constrained by some social minimum, adjustable with changing circumstances.  Thus we could satisfactorily specify the requirements of an essentially Kantian conception of justice, as requiring respect for the dignity of all persons as free and equal, rational moral agents.  While less egalitarian than what Rawls offers, it might prove an attractive alternative.  To what extent should liberty be constrained by equality in a just society?  This is a central issue that divides him from many post-Rawlsians, to a few of whom we now briefly turn.

b. Post-Rawls

Rawls’s monumental work on justice theory revitalized political philosophy in the United States and other English-speaking countries.  In this final subsection, we shall briefly survey some of the most important recent attempts to provide preferable alternatives to Rawls’s conception of justice.  They will represent six different approaches.  We shall consider, in succession, (1) the libertarian approach of Robert Nozick, (2) the socialistic one of Kai Nielsen, (3) the communitarian one of Michael Sandel, (4) the globalist one of Thomas Pogge, (5) the feminist one of Martha Nussbaum, and (6) the rights-based one of Michael Boylan.  As this is merely a quick survey, we shall not delve much into the details of their theories (limiting ourselves to a single work by each) or explore their applications or do much in the way of a critique of them.  But the point will be to get a sense of several recent approaches to developing views of justice in the wake of Rawls.

(1)    Nozick

Nozick (a departmental colleague of Rawls at Harvard) was one of the first and remains one of the most famous critics of Rawls’s liberal theory of justice.  Both are fundamentally committed to individual liberty.  But as a libertarian, Nozick is opposed to compromising individual liberty in order to promote socio-economic equality and advocates a “minimal state” as the only sort that can be socially just.  In Anarchy, State, and Utopia (1974), especially in its famous chapter on “Distributive Justice,” while praising Rawls’s first book as the most important “work in political and moral philosophy” since that of Mill, Nozick  argues for what he calls an “entitlement conception of justice” in terms of three principles of just holdings.  First, anyone who justly acquires any holding is rightly entitled to keep and use it.  Second, anyone who acquires any holding by means of a just transfer of property is rightly entitled to keep and use it.  It is only through some combination of these two approaches that anyone is rightly entitled to any holding.  But some people acquire holdings unjustly—e.g., by theft or fraud or force—so that there are illegitimate holdings.  So, third, justice can require the rectification of unjust past acquisitions.  These three principles of just holdings—“the principle of acquisition of holdings, the principle of transfer of holdings, and the principle of rectification of the violations of the first two principles”—constitute the core of Nozick’s libertarian entitlement theory of justice.  People should be entitled to use their own property as they see fit, so long as they are entitled to it.  On this view, any pattern of distribution, such as Rawls’s difference principle, that would force people to give up any holdings to which they are entitled in order to give it to someone else (i.e., a redistribution of wealth) is unjust.  Thus, for Nozick, any state, such as ours or one Rawls would favor, that is “more extensive” than a minimal state and redistributes wealth by taxing those who are relatively well off to benefit the disadvantaged necessarily “violates people’s rights” (State, pp. 149, 183, 230, 150-153, 230-231, 149).

(2)    Nielsen

Nielsen, as a socialist (against both Rawls and Nozick) considers equality to be a more fundamental ideal than individual liberty; this is more in keeping with Marxism than with the liberal/libertarian tradition that has largely stemmed from Locke.  (Whereas capitalism supports the ownership and control of the means of producing and distribution material goods by private capital or wealth, socialism holds that they should be owned and controlled by society as a whole.)  If Nozick accuses Rawls of going too far in requiring a redistribution of wealth, Nielsen criticizes him for favoring individual liberty at the expense of social equality.  In direct contrast to Rawls’s two liberal principles of justice, in “Radical Egalitarian Justice:  Justice as Equality,” Nielsen proposes his own two socialistic principles constituting the core of his “egalitarian conception of justice.”  In his first principle, he calls for “equal basic liberties and opportunities” (rather than for merely “equal basic liberties”), including the opportunities “for meaningful work, for self-determination, and political participation,” which he considers important to promote “equal moral autonomy and equal self-respect.”  Also (unlike Rawls) he does not claim any lexical priority for either principle over the other.  His sharper departure from Rawls can be found in his second principle, which is to replace the difference principle that allegedly justified socio-economic inequality.  After specifying a few qualifications, it calls for “the income and wealth” of society “to be so divided that each person will have a right to an equal share” and for the burdens of society “also to be equally shared, subject, of course, to limitations by differing abilities and differing situations.”  He argues that his own second principle would better promote “equal self-respect and equal moral autonomy” among the members of society.  Thus we might eliminate social stratification and class exploitation, in accordance with the ideals of Marxist humanism (“Equality,” pp. 209, 211-213, 222-225).

(3)    Sandel

Sandel, as a communitarian, argues (against Rawls and Nozick) that the well-being of a community takes precedence over individual liberty and (against Nielsen) over the socio-economic welfare of its members.  While acknowledging that Rawls is not so “narrowly individualistic” as to rule out the value of building social community, in Liberalism and the Limits of Justice, he maintains that the individualism of persons in the original position is such that “a sense of community” is not a basic “constituent of their identify as such,” so that community is bound to remain secondary and derivative in the Rawlsian theory.  To deny that community values help constitute one’s personal identity is to render impossible any preexisting interpersonal good from which a sense of right can be derived.  Thus, for Sandel, Rawls’s myopic theory of human nature gives him no basis for any pre-political natural rights.  So his conception of justice based on this impoverished view must fail to reflect “the shared self-understandings” of who they are as members of community that must undergird the basic structure of political society.  Through the interpersonal relationships of community, we establish “more or less enduring attachments and commitments” that help define who we are, as well as the values that will help characterize our sense of justice as a common good that cannot be properly understood by individuals detached from community.  Thus justice must determine what is right as serving the goods we embrace in a social context—“as members of this family or community or nation or people, as bearers of this history, as sons and daughters of that revolution, as citizens of this republic” rather than as abstract individuals (Limits, pp. 66, 60-65, 87, 150, 172-174, 179, 183, 179).

(4)    Pogge

Pogge develops a globalist interpretation of justice as fairness that, in a sense, is more consistent than Rawls’s own.  More specifically, it not only accepts the difference principle but wants to apply it on an international level as well as nationally.  In “An Egalitarian Law of Peoples,” Pogge observes that Rawls means his theory of justice to be relatively “egalitarian.”  And, as applied intranationally, so it is.  But, as applied internationally, it is not.  As he says, there is a disconnect “between Rawls’s conception of domestic and of global justice.”  (We should note that, like Sandel’s critique, which we just considered, Pogge’s is not a complete theory of justice, but more a modification of Rawls’s own.)  While Rawls does believe that well-off societies have a duty to assist burdened societies, he rejects the idea of a global application of his difference principle.  What Pogge is proposing is a global egalitarian principle of distributive justice.  He thinks that this will address socio-economic equalities that are to the detriment of the world’s worst-off persons.  What he proposes is “a global resources tax, or GRT.”  This means that, although each of the peoples of our planet “owns and fully controls all resources within its national territory,” it will be taxed on all of the resources it extracts.  If it uses those extracted resources itself, it must pay the tax itself.  If it sells some to other societies, presumably at least part of the tax burden will be borne by buyers in the form of higher sales prices.  “The GRT is then a tax on consumption” of our planet’s resources.  Corporations extracting resources (such as oil companies and coal mining companies) would pay their taxes to their governments which, in turn, would be responsible for transferring funds to disadvantaged societies to help the global poor.  Such payments should be regarded as “a matter of entitlement rather than charity,” an obligation of international justice.  If the governments of the poorer states were honest, they could disburse the funds; if they were corrupt, then transfers could go through United Nations agencies and/or nongovernmental organizations.  At any rate, they should be channeled toward societies in which they could improve the lot of the poor and disadvantaged.  (Of course, less well-off societies would be free to refuse such funds, if they so chose.)  But, one might wonder, would well-off societies only be motivated to pay their fair share by benevolence, a sense of justice, and possible shame at being exposed for not doing so?  No, there could be international sanctions:  “Once the agency facilitating the flow of GRT payments reports that a country has not met its obligations under the scheme, all other countries are required to impose duties on imports from, and perhaps also similar levies on exports to, this country to raise funds equivalent to its GRT obligations plus the cost of these enforcement measures.”  Pogge believes that well-off societies should recognize that his more egalitarian model of international relations is also more just than Rawls’s law of peoples (“Egalitarian,” pp. 195-196, 210, 199-202, 205, 219, 224).

(5)    Nussbaum

Nussbaum, like Pogge (and unlike Nozick and Nielsen), does not so much reject Rawls’s liberal conception of justice as extend its explicit application.  In Sex and Social Justice, she argues for a feminist interpretation of justice, using what she calls a “capabilities approach” that connects with “the tradition of Kantian liberalism,” nowadays represented by Rawls, tapping into their “notions of dignity and liberty,” as a foundation for discussing the demands of justice regarding “women’s equality and women’s human rights.”  The feminism she embraces has five key dimensions:  (1) an internationalism, such that it is not limited to any one particular culture; (2) a humanism, such as affirms a basic equal worth in all human beings and promotes justice for all; (3) a commitment to liberalism as the perspective that best protects and promotes the “basic human capacities for choice and reasoning” that render all humans as having an equal worth; (4) a sensitivity to the cultural shaping of our preferences and desires; and (5) a concern for sympathetic understanding between the sexes.  She expresses an appreciation for the primary goods at the core of Rawls’s theory, while asserting that his analysis does not go far enough.  She offers her own list of ten “central human functional capabilities” that must be respected by a just society:  (1) life of a normal, natural duration; (2) bodily health and integrity, including adequate nourishment and shelter; (3) bodily integrity regarding, for example, freedom of movement and security against assault; (4) freedom to exercise one’s senses, imagination, and thought as one pleases, which includes freedom of expression; (5) freedom to form emotional attachments to persons and things, which includes freedom of association; (6) the development and exercise of practical reason, the capacity to form one’s own conception of the good and to try to plan one’s own life, which includes the protection of freedom of conscience; (7) freedom of affiliation on equal terms with others, which involves provisions of nondiscrimination; (8) concern for and possible relationships with animals, plants, and the world of nature; (9) the freedom to play, to seek amusement, and to enjoy recreational activities; and (10) some control over one’s own political environment, including the right to vote, and one’s material environment, including the rights to seek meaningful work and to hold property.  All of these capabilities are essential to our functioning as flourishing human beings and should be assured for all citizens of a just society.  But, historically, women have been and still are short-changed with respect to them and should be guaranteed their protection in the name of justice (Sex, pp. 24, 6-14, 34, 40-42).

(6)    Boylan

Boylan has recently presented “a ‘rights-based’ deontological approach based upon the necessary conditions for human action.”  In A Just Society, he observes that human goods are more or less deeply “embedded” as conditions of human action, leading to a hierarchy that can be set forth.  There are two levels of basic goods.  The most deeply embedded of these, such as food, clothing, shelter, protection from physical harm, are absolutely necessary for any meaningful human action.  The second level of basic goods comprises (less) deeply embedded ones, such as basic knowledge and skills such as are imparted by education, social structures that allow us to trust one another, basic assurance that we will not be exploited, and the protection of basic human rights.  Next, there are three levels of secondary goods.  The most embedded of these are life enhancing, if not necessary for any meaningful action, such as respect, equal opportunity, and the capacity to form and follow one’s own plan of life and to participate actively and equally in community, characterized by shared values.  A second level of secondary goods comprises those that are useful for human action, such as having and being able to use property, being able to benefit from one’s own labor, and being able to pursue goods typically owned by most of one’s fellow citizens.  The third level of secondary goods comprises those that are least embedded as conditions of meaningful action but still desirable as luxuries, such as being able to seek pleasant objectives that most of one’s fellow citizens cannot expect to achieve and being able to compete for somewhat more than others in one’s society.  The more deeply embedded goods are as conditions of meaningful human action, the more right to them people have.  Boylan follows Kant and Rawls in holding an ultimate moral imperative is that individual human agents and their rights must be respected.  This is a matter of justice, distributive justice involving a fair distribution of social goods and services and retributive justice involving proper ways for society to treat those who violate the rules.  A just society has a duty to provide basic goods equally to all of its members, if it can do so.  But things get more complicated with regards to secondary goods.  A just society will try to provide the first level of secondary goods, those that are life enhancing, equally to all its members.  Yet this becomes more problematic with the second and third levels of secondary goods—those that are useful and luxurious—as the conditions for meaningful human action have already been satisfied by more deeply embedded ones.  The need that people have to derive rewards for their work commensurate with their achievement would seem to militate against any guarantee of equal shares in these, even if society could provide them, although comparable achievement should be comparably rewarded.  Finally, in the area of retributive justice, we may briefly consider three scenarios.  First, when one person takes a tangible good from another person, justice requires that the perpetrator return to the victim some tangible good(s) of comparable worth, plus compensation proportionate to the harm done the victim by the loss.  Second, when one person takes an intangible good from another person, justice requires that the perpetrator give the victim some tangible good as adequate compensation for the pain and suffering caused by the loss.  And, third, when one person injures another person through the deprivation of a valued good that negatively affects society, society can justly incarcerate the perpetrator for a period of time proportionate to the loss (Society, pp. x, 53-54, 56-58, 131, 138, 143-144, 164-167, 174-175, 181, 183).

In conclusion, we might observe that, in this rights-based alternative, as in the previous five (the libertarian, the socialistic, the communitarian, the globalist, and the feminist) we have considered, there is an attempt to interpret justice as requiring respect for the dignity of all persons as free and equal, rational moral agents.  This historical survey has tracked the progressive development of this Kantian idea as becoming increasingly prominent in Western theories of justice.

6. References and Further Readings

a. Primary Sources

• Thomas Aquinas, On Law, Morality, and Politics, ed. William P. Baumgarth and Richard J. Regan, S.J. (called “Law”).  Indianapolis:  Hackett, 1988.
• Thomas Aquinas, Summa Theologica, trans. Fathers of the English Dominican Province, Vol. One (called “Summa”).  New York:  Benziger Brothers, 1947.
• Aristotle, Nicomachean Ethics, trans. Terence Irwin, Second Edition (called “Nicomachean”).  Indianapolis:  Hackett, 1999.
• Aristotle, On Rhetoric, trans. George A. Kennedy (called “Rhetoric”).  New York:  Oxford University Press, 1991.
• Aristotle, Politics, trans. C. D. C. Reeve (called “Politics”).  Indianapolis:  Hackett, 1998.
• Augustine, The City of God, trans. Henry Bettenson (called “City”).  London:  Penguin Books, 1984.
• Augustine, Of True Religion, trans. J. H. S. Burleigh (called “Religion”).  Chicago:  Henry Regnery, 1959.
• Augustine, On Free Choice of the Will, trans. Thomas Williams (called “Choice”).  Indianapolis:  Hackett, 1993.
• Augustine, Political Writings, trans. and ed. Michael W. Tkacz and Douglas Kries (called “Political”).  Indianapolis:  Hackett, 1994).
• Michael Boylan, A Just Society (called “Society”).  Lanham, MD:  Rowman & Littlefield, 2004.
• Thomas Hobbes, The Elements of Law, ed. J. C. A. Gaskin (called “Elements”).  Oxford:  Oxford University Press, 1994.
• Thomas Hobbes, Leviathan, ed. Edwin Curley.  Indianapolis:  Hackett, 1994.
• Thomas Hobbes, Man and Citizen, ed. Bernard Gert (called “Citizen”).  Indianapolis:  Hackett, 1991.
• Thomas Hobbes, Writings on Common Law and Hereditary Right, ed. Alan Cromartie and Quentin Skinner (called “Common”).  Oxford:  Oxford University Press, 2008.
• David Hume, An Enquiry concerning the Principles of Morals, ed. J. B. Schneewind (called “Enquiry”).  Indianapolis:  Hackett, 1983.
• David Hume, Political Essays, ed. Knud Haakonssen (called “Essays”).  Cambridge:  Cambridge University Press, 1994.
• David Hume, A Treatise of Human Nature, ed. David Fate Norton and Mary J. Norton (called “Treatise”).  Oxford:  Oxford University Press, 2000.
• Immanuel Kant, Ethical Philosophy, trans. James W. Ellington, Second Edition (called “Ethical”).  Indianapolis:  Hackett, 1994.
• Immanuel Kant, Lectures on Ethics, trans. Louis Infield (called “Lectures”).  New York:  Harper & Row, 1963).
• Immanuel Kant, Metaphysical Elements of Justice, trans. John Ladd, Second Edition (called “Justice”).  Indianapolis:  Hackett, 1999.
• Immanuel Kant, Political Writings, trans. H. B. Nisbet, ed. Hans Reiss, Second Edition (called “Writings”).  Cambridge:  Cambridge University Press, 1991.
• John Locke, Second Treatise of Government, ed. C. B. Macpherson.  Indianapolis:  Hackett, 1980.
• Karl Marx, Selected Writings, ed. Lawrence H. Simon.  Indianapolis:  Hackett, 1994.
• John Stuart Mill, “A Few Words on Non-Intervention,” in Essays on Politics and Culture, ed. Gertrude Himmelfarb (called “Non-Intervention”).  Garden City, NY:  Anchor Books, 1963.
• John Stuart Mill, “Capital Punishment,” in Public and Parliamentary Speeches, ed. John M. Robson and Bruce L. Kinzer (called “Punishment”).  Toronto:  University of Toronto Press, 1988.
• John Stuart Mill, The Subjection of Women (called “Subjection”).  Mineola, NY:  Dover, 1997.
• John Stuart Mill, Utilitarianism and Other Writings, ed. Mary Warnock (called “Utilitarianism”).  Cleveland:  World Publishing Company, 1962.
  • This anthology also contains some Bentham and some Austin.
• Kai Nielsen, “Radical Egalitarian Justice:  Justice as Equality” (called “Equality”).  Social Theory and Practice, Vol. 5, No. 2, 1979.
• Robert Nozick, Anarchy, State, and Utopia (called “State”).  New York:  Basic Books, 1974.
• Martha C. Nussbaum, Sex and Social Justice (called “Sex”).  New York:  Oxford University Press, 1999.
• Plato, Five Dialogues, trans. G. M. A. Grube (called “Dialogues”).  Indianapolis:  Hackett, 1981.
• Plato, Gorgias, trans. Donald J. Zeyl.  Indianapolis:  Hackett, 1987.
• Plato, The Laws, trans. Trevor J. Saunders (called “Laws”).  London:  Penguin Books, 1975.
• Plato, Republic, trans. G. M. A. Grube, revised by C. D. C. Reeve.  Indianapolis:  Hackett, 1992.
• Thomas W. Pogge, “An Egalitarian Law of Peoples” (called “Egalitarian”).  Philosophy and Public Affairs, Vol. 23, No. 3, 1994.
• John Rawls, Collected Papers, ed. Samuel Freeman (called “Papers”).  Cambridge, MA:  Harvard University Press, 1999.
• John Rawls, The Law of Peoples (called “Peoples”).  Cambridge, MA:  Harvard University Press, 1999.
• John Rawls, Political Liberalism (called “Liberalism”).  New York:  Columbia University Press, 1996.
• John Rawls, A Theory of Justice (called “Theory”).  Cambridge, MA:  Harvard University Press, 1971.
• Jean-Jacques Rousseau, On the Social Contract, trans. G. D. H. Cole.  Mineola, NY:  Dover, 2003.
• Michael J. Sandel, Liberalism and the Limits of Justice (called “Limits”).  New York:  Cambridge University Press, 1982.
• Robin Waterfield, trans., The First Philosophers (called “First”).  New York:  Oxford University Press, 2000.

b. Secondary Sources

• John Arthur and William H. Shaw, ed., Justice and Economic Distribution.  Englewood Cliffs, NJ:  Prentice-Hall, 1978.
  • This is a good collection of contemporary readings, especially one by Kai Nielsen.
• Jonathan Barnes, ed., The Cambridge Companion to Aristotle.  New York:  Cambridge University Press, 1995.
  • The articles on Aristotle’s “Ethics” and “Politics” are particularly relevant.
• Brian Barry, Justice and Impartiality.  New York:  Oxford University Press, 1995.
  • This is a good study.
• Brian Barry, Theories of Justice.  Berkeley:  University of California Press, 1989.  This discussion makes up in depth what it lacks in breadth.
• Hugo A. Bedau, ed., Justice and Equality.  Englewood Cliffs, NJ:  Prentice-Hall, 1971.
  • This is an old but still valuable anthology.
• H. Gene Blocker and Elizabeth H. Smith, ed., John Rawls’ Theory of Social Justice.  Athens, OH:  Ohio University Press, 1980.
  • This is an early but still worthwhile collection of papers, with “Justice and International Relations,” by Charles R. Beitz, being particularly provocative.
• Ronald Dworkin, Taking Rights Seriously.  Cambridge, MA:  Harvard University Press, 1977.
  • See, especially, the chapter on “Justice and Rights,” which contains a critique of Rawls’s theory.
• Joel Feinberg, Doing and Deserving.  Princeton, NJ:  Princeton University Press, 1970.
  • The fourth chapter, on “Justice and Personal Desert,” is especially relevant.
• Samuel Freeman, ed., The Cambridge Companion to Rawls.  New York:  Cambridge University Press, 2003.
  • Like all the books in this series, this one offers a fine array of critical articles, with the one by Martha C. Nussbaum being particularly noteworthy.
• John-Stewart Gordon, ed. Morality and Justice: Reading Boylan’s A Just Society. Lanham, MD: Lexington Books, 2009.
  • 14 essays by scholars from 8 countries.  There is a reply by Boylan.
• Richard Kraut, ed., Plato’s Republic:  Critical Essays.  Lanham, MD:  Rowman & Littlefield, 1997.
  • See, in particular, the articles by John M. Cooper and Kraut himself.
• Rex Martin and David A. Reidy, ed., Rawls’s Law of Peoples.  Oxford:  Blackwell, 2006.
  • In particular, see “Do Rawls’s Two Theories of Justice Fit Together,” by Thomas Pogge.
• David Miller, Principles of Social Justice.  Cambridge, MA:  Harvard University Press, 1999.
  • This is a good contemporary treatment.
• David Fate Norton, ed., The Cambridge Companion to Hume.  New York:  Cambridge University Press, 1993.
  • See, especially, “The Structure of Hume’s Political Theory,” by Knud Haakonssen.
• Thomas W. Pogge, Realizing Rawls.  Ithaca, NY:  Cornell University Press, 1989.
  • This is a constructive critique of Rawls’s early work.
• Louis P. Pojman, Global Political Philosophy.  New York:  McGraw-Hill, 2003.
  • The fifth chapter focuses on justice.
• Wayne P. Pomerleau, Twelve Great Philosophers.  New York:  Ardsley House, 1997.
  • This contains discussions of Plato, Aristotle, Augustine, Aquinas, Hobbes, Hume, Kant, Mill, and (a bit on) Rawls.
• Tom Regan and Donald VanDeVeer, ed., And Justice for All.  Totowa, NJ:  Rowman and Littlefield, 1982).
  • An interesting collection, with a particularly penetrating article by Kai Nielsen.
• Henry S. Richardson, “John Rawls (1921-2002),” in the Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
  • This is a very good overview article.
• Paul Ricoeur, The Just, trans. David Pellauer.  Chicago:  University of Chicago Press, 2000.
  • This is interesting as a contemporary treatment from the continental tradition.
• Allen D. Rosen, Kant’s Theory of Justice.  Ithaca:  Cornell University Press, 1993.
  • This is a valuable, in-depth analysis.
• Alan Ryan, ed., Justice.  Oxford:  Oxford University Press, 1993.
  • This is a very good anthology of classical and contemporary readings.
• Michael J. Sandel, ed., Justice:  A Reader.  New York:  Oxford University Press, 2007.
  • This is an interesting anthology of readings that includes Sandel’s own article on “Political Liberalism.”
• Gerasimos Santas, Goodness and Justice.  Oxford:  Blackwell, 2001.
  • This is an in-depth examination of Socratic, Platonic, and Aristotelian views.
• Amartya Sen, The Idea of Justice.  Cambridge, MA:  Harvard University Press, 2009.
  • This is a wide-ranging recent study.
• John Skorupski, ed., The Cambridge Companion to Mill.  New York:  Cambridge University Press, 1998.
  • See, especially, “Mill’s Utilitarianism,” by Wendy Donner.
• Robert C. Solomon and Mark C. Murphy, ed., What Is Justice?, Second Edition.  New York:  Oxford University Press, 2000.
  • This is a nice and well-organized collection of classical and contemporary texts.
• James P. Sterba, The Demands of Justice.  Notre Dame:  University of Notre Dame Press, 1980.
  • This is a good monograph.
• James P. Sterba, ed., Justice:  Alternative Political Perspectives, Fourth Edition.  Belmont, CA:  Wadsworth/Thomson, 2003.
  • This is a well-organized collection that includes a classic feminist critique of Rawls, taken from Justice, Gender and the Family, by Susan Okin.
• Gregory Vlastos, ed., Plato:  A Collection of Critical Essays, Vol. II.  Garden City, NY:  Anchor Books, 1971.
  • See, especially, “Justice and Happiness in the Republic,” by Vlastos himself.
• Michael Walzer, Just and Unjust Wars, Third Edition.  New York:  Basic Books, 2000.
  • This is an in-depth contemporary exploration of the topic.
• Michael Walzer, Spheres of Justice.  New York:  Basic Books, 1983.
  • This is a comprehensive study.
• Eric Thomas Weber, Rawls, Dewey and Constructivism:  On the Epistemology of Justice.  London:  Continuum, 2010.
  • This is a good recent comparative analysis.
• Jonathan Westphal, ed., Justice.  Indianapolis:  Hackett, 1996.
  • This is one of the best anthologies of classic texts on this subject.

Author Information

Wayne P. Pomerleau
Email: Pomerleau@calvin.gonzaga.edu
Gonzaga University
U. S. A.

Modern Morality and Ancient Ethics

It is commonly supposed that there is a vital difference between ancient ethics and modern morality. For example, there appears to be a vital difference between virtue ethics and the modern moralities of deontological ethics (Kantianism) and consequentialism (utilitarianism). At second glance, however, one acknowledges that both ethical approaches have more in common than their stereotypes may suggest. Oversimplification, fallacious interpretations, as well as a broad variation within a particular ethical theory make it in general harder to determine the real differences and similarities between ancient ethics and modern morality. But why should we bother about ancient ethics at all? What is the utility of comparing the strengths and weaknesses of the particular approaches? The general answer is that a proper understanding of the strengths and weaknesses of virtue ethics and modern moral theories can be used to overcome current ethical problems and to initiate fruitful developments in ethical reasoning and decision-making.

This article examines the differences and similarities between ancient ethics and modern morality by analysing and comparing their main defining features in order to show that the two ethical approaches are less distinct than one might suppose. The first part of the article outlines the main ethical approaches in Ancient Greek ethics by focusing on the Cynics, the Cyrenaics, Aristotle’s virtue ethics, the Epicureans, and the Stoics. This part also briefly outlines the two leading modern ethical approaches, that is, Kantianism and utilitarianism, in more general terms in order to provide a sufficient background. The second part provides a detailed table with the main defining features of the conflicting stereotypes of ancient ethics and modern morality. Three main issues – the good life versus the good action, the use of the term “moral ought,” and whether a virtuous person can act in a non-virtuous way – are described in more detail in the third part of the article in order to show that the differences have more in common than the stereotypes may initially suggest. The fourth part deals with the idea of the moral duty in ancient ethics.

Table of Contents

1. Ancient Ethics and Modern Morality
   1. Ethics and Morality
   2. Ancient Ethics
      1. The Cynics and the Cyrenaics – The Extremes
      2. The Peripatetic School – Aristotle’s Virtue Ethics
      3. Epicureanism and Stoicism
   3. Modern Morality
      1. Kantianism
      2. Utilitarianism
   4. The Up-shot
2. The Table of Ancient Ethics and Modern Morality – A Comparison
3. Ancient Ethics and Modern Morality – The Main Differences
   1. The Good Life versus the Good Action
   2. The Moral Ought
   3. Can a Virtuous Person Act in a Non-Virtuous Way?
4. Special Problem: Kant and Aristotle – Moral Duty and For the Sake of the Noble
5. Conclusion
6. References and Further Reading

1. Ancient Ethics and Modern Morality

There are at least two main criteria that each moral theory must fulfil: first, the criterion of justification (that is, the particular moral theory should not contain any contradictions) and, second, the criterion of applicability (that is, the particular moral theory should solve concrete problems and offer ethical orientation). However, many (traditional) moral theories are unable to meet the second criterion and simply fall short of the high demands of applied ethics to solve the complex moral problems of our times. Why is this the case? The main point is that the traditional moral theories are not sufficiently well equipped to deal with completely new problems such as issues concerning nuclear power, gene technology, and cloning and so forth. Therefore, there is constant interest in updating and enhancing a particular moral theory in order to make it compatible with the latest demands. Examples are neo-Aristotelians such as Hursthouse on abortion (1991) and on nature (2007), as well as neo-Kantians such as Regan on animals (1985), Korsgaard in general and in particular on animals and nature (1996), and Altman’s edited volume on the use and limits of Kant’s practical philosophy in applied ethics (2011). This is a difficult and often very complex process.

a. Ethics and Morality

When people talk about ethical approaches in Antiquity, they refer to these approaches by using the words “ancient ethics” rather than “ancient morality”. They talk about “virtue ethics” and not about “virtue morality”. But, why is this the case? The challenging question is, according to Annas (1992: 119-120), whether ancient scholars such as Plato and Aristotle as well as the Stoics and Epicureans are really talking about morality at all, since their main focus is limited to the agent’s happiness, which obviously “doesn’t sound much like morality” (119). Even if one acknowledges the fact that happiness means a satisfactory and well-lived life according to the ethical virtues and not only a happy moment or so, it still does not sound like morality. Furthermore, the general idea in virtue ethics, that the good of other people enters the scene by being a part of one’s own good and that, for example, the notion of justice is introduced as a character trait and not as the idea of the rights of others (see, Dworkin’s phrase, “rights as trumps”), makes it obvious that there is a systematic difference between the notions of ethics and morality. Ancient ethics is about living a good and virtuous life according to the ethical virtues, that is, to become a virtuous person, while the modern notion of morality is primarily focused on the interests of other people and the idea of deontological constraints. That is, one acts morally because one has to meet certain standards and not because it supports one’s own good life. But even this simple picture might be premature depending on how one conceives the idea of “moral motivation” in ancient ethics (see, below).

Historically speaking, from a different perspective, there is no evidence which term is most legitimate. In Ancient Greek history, the Greek term for ethics is êthos and means something like character. When Aristotle analyses the good life in the Nicomachean Ethics and the Eudemian Ethics, he therefore focuses on the central topic of good and bad character traits that is virtues and vices. In this original sense, ethics means an analysis about the character or character traits. In Ancient Roman thought, which was essentially influenced by Cicero, the Greek term ethikos (the adjective to êthos) was translated with the Latin term moralis (the adjective of mores) whereas the Latin term mores, in fact, means habits and customs. It is possible to translate the Greek term êthos with habits and customs, but it is more likely that the translation of ethikos with moralis was a mistranslation. The term moralis rather refers to the Greek ethos whose primary meaning is habits and customs. If the term morality refers to mores, then the term morality means the totality of all habits and customs of a given community. The term moralis became a terminus technicus in the Latin-shaped philosophy, which covers the present meaning of the term. In modern times, the habits and customs of a given community are termed ‘conventions’, which are authoritative for the social life in society. Morality, however, is not simply a matter of mere convention but the latter often conflicts with morality (for example, an immoral convention), hence, it seems inappropriate to shorten the term in this way (Steinfath 2000). At present, there are, at least, four different possibilities to distinguish between ethics and morality:

1. Ethics and morality as distinct spheres: Ethics has to do with the pursuit of one’s own happiness or well-being and private lifestyle, that is, how we should live to make good lives for ourselves. Morality has to do with other people’s interests and deontological constraints (for example Jürgen Habermas).
2. The equation of ethics and morality (for example Peter Singer).
3. Morality as a special field in the ethical realm: Ethics is the generic term for ethical and moral issues in the above-mentioned sense. Morality is a special part of ethics (for example, Bernard Williams).
4. Morality as the object of ethics: Ethics is the philosophical theory of morality which is the systematic analysis of moral norms and values (standard reading).

The upshot is that it is always important to ask how the terms ethics and morality are used and how one uses them for oneself. It is certain that one makes a textual and not only a conceptual differentiation by claiming that the terms differ.

b. Ancient Ethics

It is impossible to give a complete depiction of the rich history of ethical reasoning and decision-making in Antiquity here, therefore the focus of this section concerns the main lines of ethical reasoning of the most important philosophical schools in the classic and Hellenistic period. This rather simplified overview is nonetheless sufficient for our purposes. One can roughly distinguish the classic and Hellenistic periods into four different but closely connected parts. The first part concerns Socrates and his arguments with the Sophists (second half of the fifth century BC); the second part covers the post-Socratian formation of important philosophical schools deeply influenced by Socratic thought for example Antisthenes’ school of the Cynics, Aristippus’ school of the Cyrenaics, and Plato’s Academy which is the most influential ancient school (second half of the fifth and fourth centuries BC). The third part is characterized, on the one hand, by the formation of one new major philosophical school, namely Aristotle’s peripatetic school, which developed from Plato’s Academy, and, on the other hand, by the exchange of arguments among the existing schools on various issues (fourth century BC). The fourth part concerns the formation of two new important philosophical schools, which become highly influential in Antiquity, first, Epicurus’ school of epicureanism standing in the tradition of the Cyrenaics and, secondly, Zeno’s school of the Stoics which partly developed from the Cynics (second half of the fourth and third century BC). All the philosophical schools – being at odds with each other – are still united by the fact that they are deeply concerned with the most important ethical questions of how to live a good life and how to achieve happiness. Their responses to these vital questions are, of course, diverse.

Figure 1. The Most Prominent Philosophical Schools in Ancient Greece

The following brief depiction focuses on the basic ethical assumptions of the philosophical schools of the Cynics and Cyrenaics, the peripatetic school, the Epicureans, and the Stoics. Socrates and Plato’s Academy are left out by virtue that Socrates did not provide any (written) systematic ethics. His unsystematic ethical position is mainly depicted in Plato’s early dialogues, for example Laches, Charmides, Protagoras and some of Xenophon’s works, such as Apology, Symposium, and Memorabilia. Plato himself did not provide any systematic ethics comparable to the other main ancient schools either, even though one can certainly reconstruct – at least to some extent – his ethical viewpoint in the dialogue Politeia. In addition, most (ethical) works of the classic and Hellenistic periods are lost in the dark of history; what remains is a collection of fragments, phrases, and (parts of) letters of various important philosophers (and commentators) standing in the tradition of particular schools at that time. Many rival views on ethics are mediated through the works of Plato and Aristotle, in which they criticize their opponents. In addition, some of these rudiments and testimonials were also mediated by famous writers and politicians such as Xenophon (fifth and fourth century BC) and the important historian of philosophy Diogenes Laertios (third century AD). Aristotle, however, is the only ancient philosopher whose two substantial and complete ethical contributions, that is, the Nicomachean Ethics and the Eudemian Ethics – leaving aside the Magna Moralia of which the authorship is unclear – have survived, even though all of his dialogues including those that are concerned with ethics and ethical issues are also lost.

i. The Cynics and the Cyrenaics – The Extremes

The founder of the school of the Cynics, Antisthenes of Athens, taught that virtue in terms of practical wisdom is a good and also sufficient for eudaimonia, that is, happiness. Badness is an evil and everything else is indifferent. In accord with Socrates, Antisthenes claimed that virtue is teachable and he also accepted the doctrine of the unity of the virtues which is the general idea that if a person possesses one ethical virtue, then he or she thereby possesses all other ethical virtues as well (for a recent contribution to this controversial doctrine, see Russell, 2009). The only good of human beings is that what is peculiar to them, that is, their ability to reason. Against the Cyrenaics he argues that pleasure is never a good. Things such as death, illness, servitude, poverty, disgrace, and hard labour are only supposed to be bad but are not real evils. One should be indifferent towards one’s honour, property, liberty, health and life (committing suicide was allowed). The Cynics, in general, lived a beggar’s life and were probably the first real cosmopolitans in human history – a feature that the Stoics wholeheartedly adopted later. They were also against the common cultural and religious rites and practices, a main feature which they shared with the Sophists. They took Socratian frugality to extremes and tried to be as independent of material goods as possible, like Diogenes of Sinope who lived in a barrel. Furthermore, one should abstain from bad things and seek apathy and tranquillity, which are important features the Stoics adopted from the Cynics as well. According to the Cynics, there are two groups of people: first, the wise people living a perfect and happy life – they cannot lose their virtues once they achieved this condition (similar to Aristotle) – and, secondly, the fools who are unhappy and make mistakes (Diogenes Laertios VI, 1 and 2; Zeller 1883: 116-121; Long 2007: 623-629).

Aristippus of Cyrene was well known and highly regarded among philosophers in Antiquity and was the first Socratian disciple who took money in exchange for lessons. He was the founder of the Cyrenaics – a famous philosophical school whose members were devoted to (sensualistic) hedonism (which certainly influenced Jeremy Bentham’s version of hedonistic utilitarianism). Thereby, the school of the Cyrenaics stands in striking contrast to the Cynics. Aristippus claims that knowledge is valuable only insofar as it is useful in practical matters (a feature that the Cyrenaics share with the Cynics); all actions should strive for the utmost pleasure since pleasure is the highest good. There are gradual qualitative differences of the goods. Unlike Aristotle the Hedonists believed that happiness understood as a long-term state is not the overall purpose in life but the bodily pleasure of the very moment, which is the goal of life. The past has gone by and the future is uncertain therefore only the here and now is decisive since the immediate feelings are the only guide to what is really genuinely valuable. Practical wisdom is the precondition of happiness in being instrumentally useful for achieving pleasure. Aristippus and the Cyrenaics were seeking maximum pleasure in each moment without being swamped by it. Aristippus – known for his cheerful nature and praiseworthy character as well as his distinguished restraint – famously claimed that one should be the master in each moment: “I possess, but I am not possessed”. A. A. Long rightly claims: “Aristippus Senior had served as the paradigm of a life that was both autonomous and effortlessly successful in turning circumstances into sources of bodily enjoyment” (2007: 636). Aristippus was a true master in making the best out of each situation; he also taught that one should be able to limit one’s wishes if they are likely to cause severe problems for oneself, to preserve self-control (a general feature he shares with Socrates), to secure one’s happiness, to seek inner freedom, and to be cheerful. Obviously his teachings of a life solely devoted to bodily pleasure – that is, his pursuit of lust and his view concerning the unimportance of knowledge – stand in striking contrast to Socrates’ teachings (as well as to Plato and Aristotle). His disciples – most notably Aristippus the Younger, Theodoros, Anniceris (who bought the release of Plato), and Hegesias – established new Cyrenaic schools offering sophisticated versions of hedonism by virtue of fruitful disputes with Epicurus and the Cynics (for a brief overview on Aristippus’ disciples, see A. A. Long 2007: 632-639 and for the teachings, for example, Diogenes Laertios II, 8; Zeller 1883: 121-125; Döring 1988. For the view that Aristippus’ hedonism is not limited to “bodily pleasures”, see Urstad 2009).

ii. The Peripatetic School – Aristotle’s Virtue Ethics      

Aristotle proposed the most prominent and sophisticated version of virtue ethics in Antiquity and his teachings have become authoritative for many scholars and still remain alive in the vital contributions of neo-Aristotelians in contemporary philosophy. His main ethical work is the Nicomachean Ethics; less prominent but still valuable and authentic is the Eudemian Ethics while Aristotle’s authorship of the Magna Moralia is highly questionable. Aristotle claims that happiness (eudaimonia) is the highest good – that is the final, perfect, and self-contained goal – to which all people strive at. In particular, happiness is the goal of life, that is, a life that is devoted to “doing” philosophy (EN X, 6–9). Whether a person can be called “happy” can only be determined at the very end of a person’s life, retrospectively. For a good and general overview on Aristotle’s ethics see Broadie (1991) and Wolf (2007).

However, the idea that life should be devoted to reasoning follows from Aristotle’s important human function argument (EN I, 5, 6) in which he attempts to show – by analogy – that human beings as such must also have a proper function in comparison to other things such as a pair of scissors (the proper function is to cutting) and a flute player (the proper function is to flute playing) and so forth. If the proper function is performed in a good way, then Aristotle claims that the particular thing has goodness (aretê). For example, if the proper function of a pair of scissors is to cutting, then the proper function of a good pair of scissors is to cutting well (likewise in all other cases). Since the proper function of human beings – according to Aristotle – is to reason, the goodness of human beings depends on the good performance of the proper human function that is to reason well. In fact, Aristotle claims that the goodness of human beings does not consist in the mere performance of the proper function but rather in their disposition. This claim is substantiated by his example of the good person and the bad person who cannot be distinguished from each other during their bedtime if one only refers to their (active) performance. The only possible way to distinguish them is to refer to their different dispositions. It is a matter of debate whether there is a particular human function as proposed by Aristotle.

All in all, one can distinguish four different lines of reasoning in Aristotle’s ethics: the virtue of the good person (standard interpretation), the idea of an action-oriented virtue ethics, the application of practical wisdom, and the idea of the intrinsic value of virtues. The different approaches are dealt with in order.

The virtue of the good person (EN II, 3, 4): according to Aristotle, an action is good (or right) if a virtuous person would perform that action in a similar situation; an action is bad or wrong (and hence prohibited) if the virtuous person would never perform such an action. Three criteria must be met, according to Aristotle, in order to ensure that an action is virtuous given that the agent is in a certain condition when he performs them: (i.) the agent must have knowledge of the circumstances of the action (the action must not happen by accident); (ii.) the action is undertaken out of deliberative choice and is done for its own sake; and (iii.) the action is performed without hesitation, that is, the action is performed by a person with a firm and stable virtuous character.

The action-oriented virtue ethics (EN II, 6, 1107a10–15): Aristotle’s virtue ethics contains some hints that he not only adheres to the standard interpretation, but also claims that there are some actions that are always morally blameworthy under any circumstances, that is, some actions are intrinsically bad. The fine or the noble and the just require the virtuous person to do or refrain from doing certain things, for example, not to murder (in particular, not to kill one’s parents), not to commit adultery, and not to commit theft. This line of reasoning contains deontological limitations insofar as the virtuous person is no longer the overall standard of evaluation, but the virtuous person herself must meet some ethical criteria in order to fulfil the external demands of, for example, “the noble” and “the just” to act virtuously.

Practical wisdom (EN VI): in some passages in book VI of the Nicomachean Ethics, Aristotle argues that it is our practical wisdom that makes our practical considerations good, both with regard to the good or virtuous life and with regard to our particular goals. He claims that a practically wise person has a special sensitivity or special perceptual skill with which to evaluate a situation in a morally correct or appropriate way. Here, the emphasis lies on the practical wisdom – as the capacity of ethical reasoning and decision-making – rather than on adhering to single ethical virtues, even though Aristotle claims that it is impossible to be practically wise without having ethical virtues and vice versa.

The intrinsic value of the virtues: following the standard interpretation of the role of the ethical virtues with regard to living a good life, Aristotle argues in the Nicomachean Ethics (EN X, 6–9) that these virtues are somewhat less important when it comes to the overall goal, that is, happiness of living a good life. The primary goal is to live a life devoted to “doing” philosophy and thereby living a good life; the secondary goal is to live a life among other people which makes it necessary to adopt the ethical virtues, as well.

iii. Epicureanism and Stoicism

Epicurus – educated by the Platonist Pamphilus and highly influenced by the important teachings of Democritus – developed his philosophical school of the Epicureans in controversies with the Cyrenaics and the Stoics and meeting their objections and challenges. The lively exchange of arguments concerning the vital issue of how to live a good life put Epicurus in the position to successfully articulate a refined and sophisticated version of hedonism, which was regarded as superior to the rival philosophical school of the Cyrenaics. He claims that sensation is the only standard of measuring good and evil. Epicurus shares the view with the Cyrenaics that all living beings strive for pleasure and try to avoid pain. But, unlike the Cyrenaic school, he argues that happiness consists of not only the very moment of bodily pleasure but lasts a whole life and also contains mental pleasure, which is – according to him – preferable to bodily pleasure. In his Letter to Menoceus, Epicurus comments on flawed views of his ethical position and claims: “For what produces the pleasant life is not continuous drinking and parties or pederasty or womanizing or the enjoyment of fish and the other dishes of an expensive table, but sober reasoning […]” (Epic. EP. Men. 132, in: Long and Sedley 2011: 114).  The ultimate goal in life is not to strive for positive pleasure but to seek for absence of pain. Unlike Aristippus, Epicurus claims in support of the importance of mental states that bodily pleasure and pain is limited to the here and now, while the soul is also concerned with the pleasurable and painful states of the past and prospective pleasure and pain. Thus, sensations based on recollections, hope and fear in the context of mental states with regard to the past and future are much stronger than the bodily pleasure of the moment. Being virtuous is a precondition of tranquillity, that is, peace and freedom from fear, which is closely connected to happiness. In addition, Epicurus taught that one should free oneself from prejudices, to master and restrict one’s desires, to live a modest life (for example a life not devoted to achieve glory and honour), which does not exclude bodily pleasure, and to cultivate close friendships, for which the Epicureans were well known (see, Diogenes Laertios X, 1; Zeller 1883: 263-267; Erler and Schofield 2007: 642-674; Long and Sedley 2000: §20-§25).

Shortly after the rise of epicureanism, Zeno of Citium – the founder of stoicism – established a new school in Athens. The members were well known for their cosmopolitism that is the idea that all human beings belong to a single community that should be cultivated (quite similar to Aristippus’ view and the Stoics), their self-contained life style and deep concern for friendship as well as their strong adherence to ataraxia that is the freedom from passions such as pleasure, desires, sorrow, and fear which jeopardize the inner independence. The Stoics were influenced by teachings of the Cynics. Human beings, according to stoicism, are able to perceive the laws of nature through reason and to act accordingly. The best life is a life according to nature (Zeller 1883: 243). Zeno believed that the most general instinct is the instinct of self-preservation; for each living being the only thing that is valuable is what conduces to the being’s self-preservation and thereby contributes to the being’s happiness. For example, in the case of rational beings only what is in accord with reason is valuable; only virtue, which is necessary and sufficient for happiness, is a good. Following the Cynics, the Stoics argue that honour, property, health and life are not goods and that poverty, disgrace, illness, and death are not evils. Against the Cyrenaics and Epicureans, they hold the view that pleasure is not a good and certainly not the highest good; they agree with Aristotle that pleasure is the consequence of our actions – if they are of the right kind – but not the goal itself. Two main doctrines are of utmost importance in the teachings of stoicism, first, the significance of ataraxia and, secondly, the idea of doing what nature demands. First, happiness is ataraxia – the freedom from passions – and a self-contained life style. Secondly, the idea that one must act in accordance with one’s own nature in terms of acting virtuously stands in striking contrast to the other philosophical schools at that time. In addition, the right motif transforms the performance of one’s duty into a virtuous action, completely independent of the outcome of the particular action (an important feature that we find again in Kant’s ethics). Following Socrates and Plato, the Stoics believed that virtue is ethical knowledge and that non-virtuous people simply lack ethical knowledge, since virtue consists in the reasonable condition of the soul, which leads to correct views. The Cynic idea of the sharp distinction between the existence of a very few wise people and many fools, that is all non-wise people, had become less sharp in the process of time. In addition, the Roman philosopher and politician Cicero (106–43 BC) is the first author whose work on the notion of duty survives, De Officiis, in which he examined the notion in great detail in the first century BC (44 BC). It should be noted, however, that the stoic philosopher Panaitios of Rhodes (180–110 BC) had already published an important book on the notion of duty prior to Cicero. Panaitios’ work is lost but we know some essential ideas from it mediated through Cicero since he often refers to Panaitios in his De Officiis. Stoicism outlived the other philosophical schools with regard to its ethics by being an attractive position for many people and leading philosophers and politicians such as Seneca (first century AD) and Marcus Aurelius (second century AD) in Ancient Rome. (see, Diogenes Laertios VII, 1; Zeller 1883: 243-253; Inwood and Donini 2007: 675-738; Long and Sedley 2000: §56-§67).

c. Modern Morality

The two main moral theories of modern virtue ethics (or neo-Aristotelianism) are Kant’s deontological ethics and utilitarianism. Both theories have been adopted and modified by many scholars in recent history in order to make them (more) compatible with the latest demands in ethical reasoning and decision-making, in particular, by meeting the objections raised by modern virtue ethics. The following briefly depicts Kantianism in its original form and the main features of utilitarianism.

i. Kantianism

The German philosopher Immanuel Kant is the founder of deontological ethics. His ethics, which he mainly put forth in the Groundwork of the Metaphysics of Morals (1785), Critique of Practical Reason (1788), and Metaphysics of Morals (1797), is one of the most prominent and highly respected theories in modernity. Kant’s ethics is deontological in the sense that one has to obey the duties and obligations which derive from his supreme principle of morality, that is, the Categorical Imperative: “Act only according to that maxim whereby you can at the same time will that it should become a universal law” (Kant 1785). The Categorical Imperative is a test for maxims which, in turn, determine whether certain acts have moral worth or not. A maxim is an individual’s subjective principle or rule of the will (in German, das subjektive Prinzip des Wollen), which tells the individual what to do in a given particular situation. If the maxim can be universalized, then it is valid and one must act upon it. A maxim cannot be universalized when it faces two severe instances: (i.) the case of logical inconsistency (the example of suicide, which is against the “perfect duty”); and, (ii.) the case of impossibility to will the maxim to be universalized (failing to cultivate one’s talents, which is against the “imperfect duty”). Perfect duties are those duties that are blameworthy if they are not met by human beings (for example the suicide example); imperfect duties allow for human desires and hence they are not as strong as perfect duties but they are still morally binding and people do not attract blame if they do not complete them (for example failing to cultivate one’s talents). Kant’s ethics is universal in the sense that the system of moral duties and obligations point at all rational beings (not only human beings). Morality is not based in interests (such as social contract theories), emotions and intuitions, or conscience, but in reason alone. This is the reason why Kant’s ethics is not heteronomous – by being a divine ethical theory in which God commands what human beings should do (for example the Bible, the Ten Commandments) or natural law conception in which nature itself commands what human beings should do by providing human beings with the faculty of reason who, in turn, detect what should be done in moral matters – but truly autonomous with regard to rational beings, who make their moral decisions in the light of pure practical reason. However, pure practical reason, in determining the moral law or Categorical Imperative, determines what ought to be done without reference to empirical contingent factors (that is, anthropology in the broad sense of the term including the empirical sciences; see preface to Groundwork) such as one’s own desires or any personal inclinations (in German Neigungen). The pure practical reason is not limited to the particular nature of human reasoning but is the source and the field of universal norms, which stem from a general notion of a rational being as such (see, Eisler 2008: 577; Paton 1967; Timmermann 2010; Altman 2011).

ii. Utilitarianism

Historically speaking, Jeremy Bentham in his Introduction to the Principles of Morals and Legislation (1789) and John Stuart Mill in Utilitarianism (1863) are the founders of utilitarianism, while Francis Hutcheson (1755) and William Paley (1785) could be seen as their legitimate predecessors by pointing out that utility should be seen as an important standard of evaluation in ethical reasoning and decision-making. Bentham claims that the duration and intensity of pleasure and pain are of utmost importance and that it is even possible – according to Bentham – to measure the right action by applying a hedonistic calculus which determines the exact utility of the actions. The action with the best hedonistic outcome should be put into practice. His position is called radical quantitative hedonism. Mill instead questions the very idea of a hedonistic calculus and argues that one must distinguish between mental and bodily pleasure by giving more weight to mental pleasures. His position is called qualitative hedonism. Mill’s basic formula of utilitarianism is as follows:

The creed which accepts as the foundation of morals, Utility, or the Greatest Happiness Principle, holds that actions are right in proportion as they tend to promote happiness, wrong as they tend to produce the reverse of happiness. By happiness is intended pleasure, and the absence of pain; by unhappiness, pain and the privation of pleasure. (Mill’s Utilitarianism, chapter 2)

There is widespread agreement that there exist numerous different utilitarian theories in modern ethics; hence it would be impossible to provide an adequate depiction of all important major strands in this brief subsection. However, the following four main aspects are typical for each utilitarian theory. (1.) The consequence principle: Utilitarianism is not about actions but about the consequences of actions. This kind of theory is a form of consequentialism, which means that the moral worth of the particular action is determined by its outcome. (2.) Happiness: Utilitarianism is a teleological theory insofar as happiness (but, not in the ancient sense of the term) is the main goal that should be achieved. This particular goal can be identified with (i.) the promotion of pleasure, (ii.) the avoidance of pain or harm, (iii.) the fulfilment of desires or considered preferences, or (iv.) with meeting some objective criteria of well-being. (3.) Greatest Happiness Principle: Utilitarianism is not about mere happiness but about “the greatest happiness” attainable. Utilitarianism is a theory with one principle that judges the consequences of a given action regarding its utility, which is the general aim of actions. The moral rightness or wrongness of actions depends on the goal of achieving the greatest happiness for the greatest number of sentient beings, in short, “the greatest happiness for the greatest number”. (4.) Maximising: The collective amount of utility regarding sentient beings affected by the action should be maximized. This line of reasoning contains strong altruistic claims because, roughly speaking, one should only choose those actions which improve other sentient beings’ happiness.

Furthermore, one major methodological distinction should be mentioned briefly since it really divides all utilitarian theories in two different groups by either applying the principle of utility to actions or rules. In act utilitarianism (or direct utilitarianism) the principle of utility is applied to the particular action; in this case, one asks whether the action in question is morally right or wrong in this particular situation. In rule utilitarianism (or indirect utilitarianism), instead, the principle of utility is applied to rules only which, in turn, are applied to the particular actions and serve as guidelines for human behaviour in order to guarantee the greatest happiness for the greatest number. Here, the vital question is whether a specific rule maximises the general utility or not. From time to time, it happens that the general utility will be maximised by rule utilitarianism to a lesser degree than it would have been the case regarding act utilitarianism. For example, one should act according to the general rule which says that one should keep one’s promises which – in the long run – maximises the general utility (rule utilitarianism). However, in some cases it would be better to adhere to act utilitarianism since it maximises the general utility to a higher degree depending on the particular situation and circumstances of the case in question (act utilitarianism).

d. The Up-shot

The depiction of the ethical views of some important philosophical schools as well as their interrelatedness in Antiquity and the outline of the two leading moral theories in modern morality show that there is – despite the systematic difference concerning the importance of the question of the good life – a significant overlap of important lines of reasoning. In addition, the supposed distinction between ancient ethics and modern morality contains many misleading claims. Socrates can be seen as the initial ignition of a broad variety of diverse virtue ethical approaches such as cynicism, the teachings of the Cyrenaics, Aristotelianism, epicureanism, and stoicism. All philosophical schools were concerned with the vital questions of how to live a good life and how to achieve happiness by pointing out what the appropriate actions were. The brief outline of the different philosophical schools in Antiquity supports this view. Modern morality is different in that its focus is on the basic question of how one should act. The ancient question of how should one live is secondary. However, modern morality in particular Kantianism and utilitarianism did not start from scratch but already had some important and highly influential ancient predecessors. For example, the Kantian idea of doing the right thing because reason dictates it has its roots in stoicism (see, Cooper 1998, Schneewind 1998) and the utilitarian idea of living a happy life according to pleasure has its roots in the teachings of the Cyrenaics (for example Bentham 1789) and Epicureans (for example Mill 1863). The history of ideas conveyed important ethical insights handed down from Antiquity to modernity. The idea that there is a clear and easy distinction between ancient (virtue) ethics and modern moral theories is premature and misleading. Indeed, there are some important differences but one must acknowledge the simple fact that there is no unity or broad consensus among ancient virtue ethicists concerning the question of how to live a good life and which actions should count as virtuous. Hence, it follows that there is no “ancient ethics” as such but many important and diverse virtue ethical approaches, which have either more or less in common with “modern morality”.

In addition, modern morality, in particular contemporary morality, is characterized by the fact that quite a few important scholars elaborated modern versions of Aristotle’s classical virtue ethics in the twentieth century. These scholars argue that virtue ethics was quite successful in solving ethical problems in Antiquity and they believe that adhering to a refined version of virtue ethics is not only useful but also superior in solving our modern moral problems. Among the most important neo-Aristotelian scholars are Anscombe (1958), Foot (1978, 2001), Hursthouse (1999), MacIntyre (1981), Nussbaum (1992, 1993, 1995), Slote (2001), Swanton (2003), and Williams (1985) who claim that the traditional ethical theories such as deontological ethics (Kantianism) and consequentialism (utilitarianism) are doomed to failure. In general they adhere, at least, to two main hypotheses: (i.) People in Antiquity already employed a very efficient way of ethical reasoning and decision-making; and, (ii.) this particular way got lost in modernity without having been properly replaced. Hence it follows that one should overcome the deficient modern ethical theories and again adhere to virtue ethics as a viable alternative without, of course, abandoning the existing ethical developments (see Bayertz 2005: 115).

The following section depicts the old but still persisting stereotypical differences between ancient ethics and modern morality in order to further deepen our understanding about the supposed and real differences and similarities of both ethical approaches.

2. The Table of Ancient Ethics and Modern Morality – A Comparison

This self-explanatory table presents a simple but instructive comparison of the defining features of the stereotypes of ancient ethics and modern morality (for a similar table see Bayertz 2005: 117).

Table 1: Ancient Ethics and Modern Morality

3. Ancient Ethics and Modern Morality – The Main Differences

a. The Good Life versus the Good Action

The most common stereotype with regard to ancient ethics and modern morality concerns the vital issue that ancient ethics is only about the question “What is the good life” and that modern moral theories only deal with the question “What should one do” or “How should one act”. Many stereotypes certainly depict some truth, but there is almost always a lot of room for a better understanding of the differences and similarities of the particular issue. To be more precise with regard to this issue, it is true that ancient ethics concerns the vital question of how to live a good life and to become a virtuous person by acting in accordance with the ethical virtues. However, the idea that virtue ethics does not deal with actions and hence is unable to provide concrete answers to ethical problems is premature; it is not only modern moral theories that deal with actions (see, Hursthouse 1999, chapters 1-3; Slote 2001, chapter 1; Swanton 2003, chapter 11). An ethical virtue, according to Aristotle, needs to be completely internalized by its agent through many actions of the same type so that the person is able to accomplish a firm disposition. In other words, a brave person who has the virtue of courage has to perform many brave actions in the area of fear and confidence in order to accomplish a brave disposition. Performing the appropriate actions is the only way one can do this. Indeed, modern moral theories are rather focused on the question of what should one do in a particular situation, and usually ethicists do not pay much attention to the question of living a good life. Ancient ethicists, instead, believe that one cannot separate both issues.

A related issue that seems to strongly support the initial idea concerns the claim that, on the one hand, ancient ethics is self-centred because it only focuses on the agent’s interests in living a good life and becoming a virtuous person and, on the other hand, that modern morality is other-regarding by only focusing on the interests of other people. Broadly speaking, ancient ethics is egoistical and modern morality is altruistic. The interests of other people in virtue ethics enter the stage by being incorporated into the person’s own interest in becoming virtuous and living a good life. In her article Ancient Ethics and Modern Morality, Annas examines this point in more detail and claims “the confusion comes from the thought that if the good of others is introduced into the agent’s own final good, it cannot really be the good of others, but must in some way be reduced to what matters to the agent”.  She points out that the confusion might be that “the good of others must matter to me because it is the good of others, not because it is part of my own good” (Annas 1992: 131). Annas thinks that this is compatible with the overall final good of the virtuous person since the good of others matters to the virtuous person not because it is part of the agent’s own good but because it is the good of others.

Other people, however, might claim that the difference is between “morality” and “legality”, to use a Kantian distinction. In this context, legality means simply to fulfil the moral claims that other people have; morality means to fulfil the moral claims that other people have and, in addition, to have the right motive in doing so, that is, to act out of “the good will” – to act out of a sense of moral obligation or duty. Translated into “ancient” language, the virtuous person should consider other people’s interests not because she feels indifferent to them or because their interests are only instrumentally useful to her as agent, but because the virtuous person wholeheartedly believes, feels, and acknowledges the fact that the other people’s interests are important in their own right. Another example is Aristotle who believes that the good person is living a good life if and only if she devotes her life to “philosophy” and, secondarily, lives a social life among other people. The latter requires the usage of ethical virtues, which are by nature other-regarding; the former does not require the usage of ethical virtues (see, Aristotle EN X, 6–9), even though, according to Aristotle, one cannot be a practically wise person without being virtuous, and vice versa. Both concepts are mutually dependent (EN VI).

One might claim that self-interest and the interests of other people do not stand in contrast to each other in ancient ethics but converge by adhering to an objective idea of the good (see, Bayertz 2005). The line between moral questions that concern the interests of other people and ethical questions that concern the well-being of the particular agent is disfigured beyond recognition. In modern morality, however, there is a clear difference because the question of the good life is secondary, and is systematically not important for the question of how one should act in a particular situation. Modern moral theories are rather subjective in character and hence lack the strong commitments of virtue ethical theories concerning their objective basis, as well as their claims regarding elitism and the devaluation of the moral common sense. The upshot is, however, that there is a systematic difference between ancient ethics and modern morality concerning the way in which moral problems are solved, but the idea that ancient ethics is egoistic and does not appeal to actions is premature and simply wrong.

b. The Moral Ought

Anscombe points out in her classical paper Modern Moral Philosophy (1958) that modern morality is doomed to failure because it only focuses on the analysis of language and notions and, in particular, it adheres to the fallacious idea of the moral duty. She argues that the idea of the moral duty and the moral ought used in deontological ethics originally comes from religious reasoning and theological ethics, where God was the ultimate source of morality and where the people had to obey God’s commands. Here, the ideas of a moral duty and a moral ought were appropriate. In secular ethics, however, there is no general consent to the idea of a moral duty that is universally binding on all rational people. The idea of a moral duty, according to Anscombe, should be replaced by the notion of virtue. Furthermore, Schopenhauer convincingly claims in his book On the Basis of Morality that even in the case of religious ethics there is no categorical moral duty, since people obey God’s moral rules simply because they do not want to be punished, if they decide not to act accordingly. But this means that the moral duty is hypothetical rather than categorical. It is commonly said that in ancient ethics there is no moral duty and no moral ought simply because the Greek and Romans lack those particular notions. However, from the bare fact that they lack the notions of moral duty and moral ought, one cannot conclude that they also lack the particular phenomena as well (Bayertz 2005: 122). In addition, one might claim that his point still misses the general idea of using similar notions as main ethical key terms, which reflects a certain particular way of ethical reasoning and decision-making. Whether there is something like a ‘moral ought’ in ancient virtue ethics that is comparable to deontological ethics will be briefly examined below by focusing on Aristotle’s ethics. 

c. Can a Virtuous Person Act in a Non-Virtuous Way?

According to ancient ethics, a completely virtuous person, who is the bearer of all ethical virtues, is unable to act in a non-virtuous way. If a person bears one virtue, he thereby bears all other virtues as well (that is the thesis of the unity of the virtues). The practically wise person – according to Ancient ethicists – will always act in accordance with the ethical virtues. In other words, the virtuous person is always master of her emotions and, in general, will never be swamped by her emotions, which otherwise might have led her to act in a non-virtuous way. Generally speaking, this is a quite demanding line of argumentation since it can be the case, at least according to our modern way of thinking, that a brave person who has the virtue of courage might not be able to show the virtue of liberality. However, even if one acknowledges that person A is a virtuous person, one might not be convinced that this person will never be able to act in a non-virtuous way. This particular problem has to do with the famous hypothesis of ‘the unity of the virtues’ (for a recent contribution to this problem, see Russell, 2009). In modern morality, utilitarianism, for example, convincingly distinguishes between the evaluation of the character of a person and his or her actions. It can easily be the case, according to utilitarianism, that a morally bad person performs a morally right action or that a morally good person performs a morally wrong action. This distinction is impossible to draw for proponents of (classic) virtue ethics because an ethically right action always presupposes that the person has an ethically good character.

4. Special Problem: Kant and Aristotle – Moral Duty and For the Sake of the Noble

There is a widely shared agreement among philosophers that Kant’s deontological ethics and Aristotle’s virtue ethics can be easily distinguished by acknowledging the simple fact that Kant is concerned with acting from duty or on the moral principle or because one thinks that it is morally right; while Aristotle’s approach completely lacks this particular idea of moral motivation and, hence, it would be unsound to claim that the virtuous person is morally obligated to act in a way similar to the Kantian agent. In other words, there is no such thing as acting from a sense of duty in virtue ethics. The common view has been challenged by, for example, neo-Aristotelians (for example Hursthouse 2010) who claim that there is not only a strong notion of moral motivation in Aristotle’s approach, but also that the virtuous person is better equipped to meet the demands of acting from a sense of duty than the Kantian moral agent. The following sketches out the main line of reasoning (see, also Engstrom and Whiting 1998; Jost and Wuerth 2011).

Hursthouse claims in her book On Virtue Ethics that “there is a growing enthusiasm for the idea that the ideal Kantian agent, the person with a good will, who acts “from a sense of duty”, and the ideal neo-Aristotelian agent, who acts from virtue – from a settled state of character – are not as different as they were once supposed to be” (2010: 140). Her view is supported by some important works of Hudson (1990), Audi (1995), and Baron (1995). This fact, however, has also been acknowledged by neo-Kantian philosophers such as Korsgaard (1998) and Herman (1998). In this respect it reflects a lack of awareness about current developments in virtue ethics and neo-Kantianism if one still up-holds the claim of the clear distinction between ancient ethics and modern morality, in particular, concerning Aristotle and Kant that has been proposed for hundreds of years. A related issue concerning the question of whether there is a fundamental distinction between aretaic and deontic terms has been critically discussed by Gryz (2011) who argues against Stocker (1973) who claims that “good” and “right” mean the same thing. Gryz is convinced that even if both groups of terms converge (as close as possible), there will still either remain an unbridgeable gap or in case that one attempts to define one group of terms by the other group, it follows that something is left behind which cannot be explained by the second group. This contemporary debate shows that there is still no common view on the relationship between ancient ethics and modern morality.

Kant claims in the Groundwork that the morally motivated agent acts from good will. In more detail, to act from duty or to act because one thinks that it is morally right is to perform an action because one thinks that its maxim has the form of a law (Korsgaard 1998: 218). For example, if a person is in need the Kantian agent does the right action not because – as Korsgaard claims – that it is her purpose to simply do her duty, but because the person chooses the action for its own sake that means her purpose is to help (Korsgaard 1998: 207).

Even if the Ancient Greeks lacked the particular notions that can be translated as moral ought, duty, right, and principle (for example Gryz 2011, Hursthouse 2010), it seems nonetheless correct to claim that the idea of doing the right thing because it is right or because one is required to do it is also a well-known phenomenon in classic virtue ethics in general and with regard to Aristotle and stoicism in particular. There are quite a few passages in the Nicomachean Ethics in which Aristotle clearly claims that morally good actions are done for their own sake or because it is the morally right thing to do:

Now excellent actions are noble and done for the sake of the noble. (EN IV, 2, 1120a23–24)

Now the brave man is as dauntless as man may be. Therefore, while he will fear even the things that are not beyond human strength, he will fear them as he ought and as reason directs, and he will face them for the sake of what is noble; for this is the end of excellence. (EN III, 10 1115b10-13)

The standard of all things is the good and the good man; he is striving for the good with all his soul and does the good for the sake of the intellectual element in him. (EN IX, 4, 1166a10–20)

The good man acts for the sake of the noble. (EN IX, 8, 1168a33-35)

For the wicked man, what he does clashes with what he ought to do, but what the good man ought to do he does; for the intellect always chooses what is best for itself, and the good man obeys his intellect. (EN IX, 8, 1169a15–18)

If the virtuous person acts because she thinks that it is the right thing to do, because she acts for the sake of the noble without any inclination other than to do good for the sake of the noble, then she is comparable with the Kantian moral agent. For example, according to Aristotle the noble is “that which is both desirable for its own sake and also worthy of praise” (Rhetoric I, 9, 1366a33); and in 1366b38–67a5 he holds the view that nobility is exhibited in actions “that benefit others rather than the agent, and actions whose advantages will only appear after the agent’s death, since in these cases we can be sure the agent himself gets nothing out of it” (Korsgaard 1998: 217). Hence it follows, the virtuous person will not be able to act in a non-virtuous way because he or she acts from a strong inner moral obligation to act according to the morally right thing, since it is the very nature of the virtuous person to act virtuously. The Kantian agent, instead, sometimes acts according to the universal law and hence performs a morally right action, and on other occasions he or she fails to do so. This is because he or she has no stable and firm disposition to always act in accordance with the universal law. That is the very reason why the Aristotelian virtuous person can be seen as an agent who is not only acting from duty in the sense of doing the right thing because it is right, but also because the virtuous person constantly perceives and adheres to the moral duty, that is, to act virtuously.

5. Conclusion

The upshot is, however, that the vital question of how to live a good life cannot be separated from the essential question of how one should act. Conceptually and phenomenologically, both questions are intimately interwoven and a complete ethical theory will always be concerned with both issues, independently of whether the theory is of ancient or modern origin.

6. References and Further Reading

• Altman, M. 2011. Kant and Applied Ethics: The Uses and Limits of Kant’s Practical Philosophy. Oxford: Wiley-Blackwell.
• Annas, J. 1992. “Ancient Ethics and Modern Morality.” Philosophical Perspectives 6: 119-136.
• Anscombe, E. 1958. “Modern Moral Philosophy.“ Philosophy 33 (124): 1-19.
• Apelt, O, trans. 1998. Diogenes Laertius: Leben und Meinungen berühmter Philosophen. Hamburg: Meiner.
• Aristotle. 1985. “Nicomachean Ethics.” Translated by W.D. Ross. In Complete Works of Aristotle, edited by J. Barnes, 1729-1867. Princeton: Princeton University Press.
• Aristotle. 2007. Rhetoric. Translated by George A. Kennedy. New York: Oxford University Press.
• Audi, R. 1995. “Acting from Virtue.” Mind 104 (415): 449-471.
• Baron, M. 1995. Kantian Ethics Almost Without Apology. New York: Cornell University Press.
• Bayertz, K. 2005. “Antike und moderne Ethik.“ Zeitschrift für philosophische Forschung 59 (1): 114-132.
• Bentham, J. 1962. „The Principles of Morality and Legislation” [1798]. In J. Bowring (ed.), The Works of Jeremy Bentham, edited by J. Bowring, 1-154. New York: Russell and Russell.
• Broadie, S. 1991. Ethics with Aristotle. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Cicero, M.T. 2001. On Obligations. Translated by P.G. Walsh. Oxford, New York: Oxford University Press.
• Cooper, J.M. 1998. “Eudaimonism, the Appeal to Nature, and ‘Moral Duty’ in Stoicism.” In Aristotle, Kant, and the Stoics: Rethinking Happiness and Duty, edited by S. Engstrom and  J. Withing, 261-284. Cambridge, New York: Cambridge University Press.
• Döring, K. 1988. Der Sokratesschüler Aristipp und die Kyrenaiker. Stuttgart, Wiesbaden: Franz Steiner.
• Dworkin, R. 1984. “Rights as Trumps.” In Theories of Rights, edited by J. Waldron, 152-167. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Eisler, R. 2008. Kant Lexikon: Nachschlagewerk Zu Kants Sämtlichen Schriften, Briefen Und Handschriftlichem Nachlaß. Hildesheim: Weidmannsche Verlagsbuchhandlung.
• Engstrom, S. and J. Withing. 1998. Aristotle, Kant, and the Stoics. Rethinking Happiness and Duty.  Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Erler, M. and M. Schofield. 2007. “Epicurean Ethics.” In The Cambridge History of Hellenistic Philosophy, edited by K. Algra, J. Barnes, J. Mansfield and M. Schofield, 642-669. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Foot, P. 1978. Virtues and Vices and other Essays in Moral Philosophy. Berkeley: University of California Press.
• Foot, P. 2001. Natural Goodness. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
• Gryz, J. 2010. “On the Relationship Between the Aretaic and the Deontic.” Ethical Theory and Moral Practice 14 (5): 493–501.
• Herman, B. 1998. “Making Room for Character.” In Aristotle, Kant, and the Stoics. Rethinking Happiness and Duty, edited by S. Engstrom and J. Withing, 36-60.  Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
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• Hursthouse, R. 1991. “Virtue Theory and Abortion.” Philosophy and Public Affairs 20 (3): 223-246.
• Hursthouse, R. 2010. On Virtue Ethics. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Hursthouse, R. 2007. “Environmental Virtue Ethics.” In Working Virtue: Virtue Ethics and Contemporary Moral Problems, edited by R.L. Walker and P.J. Ivanhoe, 155-171. New York: Oxford University Press.
• Hutcheson, F. 2005. A System of Moral Philosophy, in Two Books [1755]. London: Continuum International Publishing Group.
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• Jost, L. and J. Wuerth. 2011. Perfecting Virtue: New Essays on Kantian Ethics and Virtue Ethics. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Kant., I. 1991. Metaphysics of Morals [1797]. Translated by M. Gregor. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Kant, I. 1997. Critique of Practical Reason [1788]. Translated by M. Gregor. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Kant, I. 2005. Groundwork for the Metaphysics of Morals [1785]. Translated by A.W. Wood. New Haven CT:  Yale University Press.
• Korsgaard, C.M. 1996. Sources of Normativity. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Korsgaard, C.M. 1998. “From Duty and From the Sake of the Noble: Kant and Aristotle on Morally Good Action.” In Aristotle, Kant, and the Stoics. Rethinking Happiness and Duty, edited by S. Engstrom and J. Withing, 203-236. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Long, A.A. 2007. “The Socratic Legacy.” In The Cambridge History of Hellenistic Philosophy, edited by K. Algra, J. Barnes, J. Mansfield and M. Schofield, 617-639. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Long, A.A and D.N. Sedley. 2000. The Hellenistic Philosophers, Volume 2: Greek and Latin Texts with Notes and Bibliography. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
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• MacIntyre, A. 1981.  After Virtue. London: Duckworth.
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• Nussbaum, M.C. 1992. “Human Functioning and Social Justice. In Defense of Aristotelian Essentialism.” Political Theory 20 (2): 202-246.
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• Nussbaum, M. 1995. “Aristotle on Human Nature and the Foundations of Ethics.” In World, Mind, and Ethics: Essays on the Ethical Philosophy of Bernard Williams, edited by J.E.J. Altham and R. Harrison, 86-131. Cambridge, New York: Cambridge University Press.
• Paley, W. 2002. The Principles of Moral and Political Philosophy [1785]. Indianapolis: Liberty Fund.
• Paton, H. J. 1967. The Categorical Imperative: A Study in Kant’s Moral Philosophy. London: Hutchinson & co.
• Regan, T. 1985.  The Case for Animal Rights. Berkeley: University of California Press.
• Russell, D.C. 2009. Practical Intelligence and the Virtues. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
• Schneewind, J.B. 1998. “Kant and Stoic Ethics.” In Aristotle, Kant, and the Stoics: Rethinking Happiness and Duty, edited by S. Engstrom and J. Withing, 285-302. Cambridge, New York: Cambridge University Press.
• Schopenhauer, A. 1995. On the Basis of Morality [1841]. Translated by E.F.J. Payne. Providence: Berghahn Books.
• Slote, M. 2001. Morals from Motives. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Steinfath, H. 2000. „Ethik und Moral.“ In Vorlesung: Typen ethischer Theorien, 1-21 (unpublished)
• Stocker, M. 1973. “Rightness and Goodness: Is There a Difference?” American Philosophical Quarterly 10 (2): 87–98.
• Swanton, C. 2003. Virtue Ethics: A Pluralistic View. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Timmermann, Jens. 2010. Kant’s Groundwork of the Metaphysics of Morals. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Urstad, K. 2009. “Pathos, Pleasure and the Ethical Life in Aristippus.” Journal of Ancient Philosophy III (1): 1-22.
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• Wolf, Ursula. 2002. Aristoteles’ “Nikomachische Ethik”. Darmstadt: Wissenschaftliche Buchgesellschaft.
• Zeller, E. 1883. Geschichte der Griechischer Philosophie, Stuttgart: Magnus.

Author Information

John-Stewart Gordon
Email: jgordon@uni-koeln.de
University of Cologne, Germany
Vytautas Magnus University Kaunas, Lithuania