Epistemic Luck

Epistemic luck is a generic notion used to describe any of a number of ways in which it can be accidental, coincidental, or fortuitous that a person has a true belief. For example, one can form a true belief as a result of a lucky guess, as when one believes through guesswork that “C” is the right answer to a multiple-choice question and one’s belief just happens to be correct. One can form a true belief via wishful thinking; for example, an optimist’s belief that it will not rain may luckily turn out to be correct, despite forecasts for heavy rain all day. One can reason from false premises to a belief that coincidentally happens to be true. One can accidentally arrive at a true belief through invalid or fallacious reasoning. And one can fortuitously arrive at a true belief from testimony that was intended to mislead but unwittingly reported the truth. In all of these cases, it is just a matter of luck that the person has a true belief.

Until the twenty-first century, there was nearly universal agreement among epistemologists that epistemic luck is incompatible with knowledge. Call this view “the incompatibility thesis.” In light of the incompatibility thesis, epistemic luck presents epistemologists with three distinct but related challenges. The first is that of providing an accurate analysis of knowledge (in terms of individually necessary and jointly sufficient conditions for “S knows that p,” where ‘S’ represents the knower and ‘p’ represents the proposition known). An adequate analysis of knowledge must succeed in specifying conditions that rule out all instances of knowledge-destroying epistemic luck. The second challenge is to resolve the skeptical paradox that the ubiquity of epistemic luck generates: As will become clear in section 2c, epistemic luck is an all-pervasive phenomenon. Coupling this fact with the incompatibility thesis entails that we have no propositional knowledge. The non-skeptical epistemologist must somehow reconcile the strong intuition that epistemic luck is not compatible with knowledge with the equally evident observation that it must be. The third challenge concerns the special skeptical threat that epistemic luck seems to pose for more reflective forms of knowledge, such as knowing that one knows. Each of these challenges will be explored in the present article.

Table of Contents

1. Epistemic Luck and the Analysis of Knowledge
   1. The Incompatibility Thesis
   2. The Justified-True-Belief Analysis of Knowledge
   3. The Gettier Problem
   4. Purported Solutions to the Gettier Problem
      1. No False Grounds
      2. No Essential False Grounds
      3. Defeasibility Approaches
      4. The Externalist Turn
      5. The Causal Theory of Knowing
   5. Controversial Cases
      1. Beneficial Falsehoods
      2. Misleading Evidence One Does Not Possess
      3. Impact of These Cases
   6. Where Things Stand
2. The Paradox of Epistemic Luck
   1. The Knowledge Thesis
   2. The Incompatibility Thesis (Again)
   3. The Ubiquity Thesis
   4. The Skeptical Challenge
   5. Rejecting the Incompatibility Thesis
   6. Knowledge-Destroying Epistemic Luck
      1. Evidential vs. Veritic Luck
      2. Justification-Oriented Luck
      3. Modal Veritic Luck
   7. Second-Wave Anti-Luck Epistemologies
      1. Sensitivity
      2. Safety
   8. Paradox Lost
3. Epistemic Luck and Knowing that One Knows
   1. Internalism, Epistemic Luck, and the Problem of Knowing that One Knows
   2. Epistemic Luck and Reflective Knowledge
4. Conclusion
5. References and Further Reading

1. Epistemic Luck and the Analysis of Knowledge

There is no settled agreement as to how best to characterize the accidentality or fortuitousness of an epistemically lucky true belief. Some have attempted to cash out the accidentality of epistemically lucky beliefs modally. For example, Mark Heller (1999) contends that person S’s belief that p is epistemically lucky (and hence not knowledge) if p is true in the actual world, but there is at least one world, in a contextually-determined set of possible worlds, where S’s belief that p is false. On Duncan Pritchard’s modal characterization (2005), S’s belief is epistemically lucky if it is true in the actual world, but false in a majority of nearby possible worlds where S forms the belief in the same way. Others (Riggs 2007; Coffman 2007) insist that epistemic luck be cashed out in terms of a lack of control condition. Each of these proposals has been criticized in the literature. Despite the lack of agreement concerning the exact nature of epistemic luck, there is widespread agreement that epistemic luck is incompatible with knowledge.

One of the earliest recorded illustrations of knowledge-destroying luck can be found in Plato’s Theaetetus. In this dialogue, Socrates inquires as to what knowledge is. When Theaetetus suggests that knowledge is true belief, Socrates quickly convinces him that he is mistaken by noting that a jury may luckily arrive at a true belief either as a result of the rhetorical skill of a jurist intent on getting a certain verdict or on the basis of unsubstantiated hearsay, and in either case, the lucky true belief would fall short of knowledge. The Socratic challenge posed in the Theaetetus is to specify what must be added to true belief to get knowledge. To meet that challenge, one must provide an analysis of knowledge that correctly identifies the conditions that are individually necessary and jointly sufficient for S to know that p (where ‘S’ represents the knower and ‘p’ represents the proposition known). As will become readily apparent in what follows, the possibility of epistemic luck makes the already difficult task of meeting the Socratic challenge all the more difficult.

a. The Incompatibility Thesis

Epistemologists have long agreed with Plato that epistemic luck is incompatible with knowledge. To see just how widespread commitment to the incompatibility thesis is, consider the remarks of just few representative epistemologists. In The Problems of Philosophy (1912, p. 131), Bertrand Russell asks the question: “Can we ever know anything at all, or do we merely sometimes by good luck believe what is true?”—the implication being that lucky true belief is not knowledge. In Theory of Knowledge (1990, p. 12), Keith Lehrer stresses that knowledge requires more than lucky true acceptance: “If I accept something without evidence or justification . . . and, as luck would have it, this turns out to be right, I fall short of knowing that what I have accepted is true.” In Reasons and Knowledge (1981, p. 31), Marshall Swain maintains that: “lucky guesses do not constitute factual knowledge.” In his Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy article on the analysis of knowledge (2006), Matthias Steup expressly endorses the incompatibility thesis: “Let us refer to a belief’s turning out to be true because of mere luck as epistemic luck. It is uncontroversial that knowledge is incompatible with epistemic luck.” In his Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy article on epistemology (2007), David Truncellito concurs: “a lucky guess cannot constitute knowledge. Similarly, misinformation and faulty reasoning do not seem like a recipe for knowledge, even if they happen to lead to a true belief.” In Epistemic Luck (2005, p. 1), Duncan Pritchard calls attention to “the seemingly universal intuition that knowledge excludes luck, or, to put it another way, that the epistemic luck that sometimes enables one to have true beliefs . . . is incompatible with knowledge.”

The nearly universal intuition that epistemic luck is incompatible with knowledge is rooted in compelling examples like the following:

Jack of Hearts

Dylan is an avid euchre player. One night between hands, the dealer asks Dylan which card he believes to be on the top of the freshly shuffled euchre deck. Dylan thinks for a moment and, recalling his fondness of bowers, comes to believe that the top card is the jack of hearts. After Dylan reports his belief, the dealer turns over the top card, which just so happens to be the jack of hearts.

Since the probability of the jack of hearts being the top card of a randomly shuffled euchre deck is 1/32, it is just a matter of luck that Dylan’s belief was true. Dylan certainly didn’t know that the jack of hearts was the top card. He just happened to guess correctly, and knowledge requires more than lucky guesswork.

b. The Justified-True-Belief Analysis of Knowledge

Examples like Jack of Hearts clearly show that true belief is not sufficient for knowledge. What, then, must be added to true belief in order to get knowledge? Prior to 1963, most epistemologists maintained that justification is what is required to convert true belief to knowledge, and as a result, they endorsed the justified-true-belief analysis of knowledge:

(JTB)   For any subject S and any proposition p, S knows that p if and only if:

(i) p is true,

(ii) S believes that p [Bp], and

(iii) S is justified in believing that p [Jp].

Fallibilists and infallibilists disagree about the kind of justification required by (iii). Infallibilists maintain that knowledge requires infallible justification. Infallible justification entails the truth of the proposition for which it is justification. Fallibilists, on the other hand, endorse a weaker justification requirement. They contend that the kind of justification requisite for knowledge need only render probable, but need not entail, that for which it is justification.

At first blush, it might look as if infallible justification holds the key to eliminating epistemic luck and is, thus, the kind of justification needed for knowledge. After all, if S believes that p on the basis of infallible truth-entailing justification for p, it is impossible for S to be mistaken with respect to p. Unfortunately, the legacy of infallibilism is nearly wholesale skepticism. The point can be demonstrated as follows: Since our evidence for the non-cogito contingent empirical propositions we believe never entails the truth of those propositions, it follows that if the kind of justification required for knowledge is infallible truth-entailing justification, then we are never justified in believing, and hence never know, that such propositions are true. An infallibilist justification requirement would go a long way toward eliminating epistemic luck, but it would do so at the cost of making empirical knowledge impossible—hardly an adequate non-skeptical solution to the problem of epistemic luck.

Recognizing the skeptical implications of infallibilism, most contemporary epistemologists have embraced fallibilism so that empirical knowledge remains at least in principle possible. Fallibilistic justification is thought to rule out epistemic luck by making one’s belief extremely probable. When one’s belief that p is extremely probable, it is not just a matter of luck that one’s belief is true. Recall Jack of Hearts. Prior to the dealer’s turning over the top card, Dylan has no evidence as to what the top card is. As such, it is extremely improbable that the top card is the jack of hearts. Consider how Dylan’s epistemic situation changes after the dealer turns over the top card, and Dylan sees the jack of hearts. Now Dylan has good perceptual evidence that the card is the jack of hearts. Given his newly-acquired perceptual evidence, it is now extremely probable that the card is the jack of hearts, and as a result, it is no longer just a matter of luck that his belief that it is the jack of hearts is true. Granted, it is possible that a Cartesian evil demon could have caused Dylan to hallucinate the jack of hearts right as the dealer flipped over some other card (which illustrates that Dylan’s perceptual evidence doesn’t entail that the card is the jack of hearts), and so, his evidence doesn’t eliminate all chance of error; but it does make the chance of error extremely low, and when error is extremely improbable, it is not simply a matter of luck that one’s belief is true.

c. The Gettier Problem

Although the role of the justification condition in the JTB-analysis is to rule out lucky guesses as instances of knowledge, it remains possible, given any fallibilistic account of justification, to have a justified belief that is only luckily true, a fact that went largely unnoticed until the publication of Edmund Gettier’s seminal article “Is Justified True Belief Knowledge?” (1963). Therein, Gettier provides two compelling counterexamples to the JTB-analysis of knowledge. He dubs these examples “Case I” and “Case II.” Both cases involve a person who justifiably comes to believe a true proposition by validly deducing it from a justified-but-false belief. Consider first Gettier’s Case II.

Case II: Smith has good evidence for believing that Jones owns a Ford [J]. Indeed, Smith’s evidence for thinking that Jones owns a Ford is at least as strong as the evidence that we typically have for thinking that our friends and family members own the cars they do. Smith’s evidence consists of the following: As far back as Smith can remember, Jones has always owned a Ford; just that morning, Jones gave Smith a ride while driving a Ford; and Smith was with Jones a few months back when Jones purchased a Ford exactly like the one she was driving when she offered Smith the ride earlier that morning. Based on this evidence, Smith justifiedly believes that Jones owns a Ford [J]. On the basis of her justified belief that J, Smith justifiedly deduces and comes to believe the disjunction that either Jones owns a Ford or Brown is in Barcelona [J or B], despite having no idea of Brown’s whereabouts. As it turns out, Jones no longer owns a Ford. She recently sold her Ford and is driving a rental. However, purely by coincidence, Brown happens to be in Barcelona. Obviously, it is just a matter of luck that Smith’s justified belief that J or B is true. Nearly every epistemologist who has considered this case agrees that Smith’s luck-infused justified-true-belief that J or B falls short of knowledge.

Here is a slightly modified version Gettier’s other example. Case I: While waiting for a job interview, Smith sees Nelson take the coins out of her pocket, count them (ten coins in all), and then put them back in her pocket. Smith also overhears the boss on the phone telling someone that Nelson is the person who will get the job. On the basis of this evidence, Smith justifiedly believes the conjunction:

(N)  Nelson will get the job, and Nelson has ten coins in her pocket.

On basis of her justified belief that N, Smith deduces and justifiedly comes to believe:

(P)  The person who will get the job has ten coins in her pocket.

Despite Smith’s evidence, N is false. The boss misspoke on the phone. Actually, it is Smith, not Nelson, who will get the job, and purely by chance, Smith happens to have exactly ten coins in her pocket. Once again, it is just a matter of luck that Smith’s belief—this time her belief that P—is true. With these two examples, Gettier showed that fallibilistic justification is incapable of eliminating all forms of knowledge-destroying epistemic luck and that, as a result, justified true belief is not sufficient for knowledge.

d. Purported Solutions to the Gettier Problem

Gettier’s paper gave rise to a plethora of articles attempting to solve the problem that now bears his name. Many of these purported solutions sought to resolve the problem by supplementing the JTB-analysis with a fourth condition, while others abandoned the JTB-analysis in favor of non-traditional ajustificational accounts of knowledge. Consider first some of the prominent fourth condition responses.

i. No False Grounds

In both of Gettier’s examples, Smith justifiably infers a true belief from a justified-but-false belief, and it has seemed to many that a true belief is not knowledge when it is deduced from a false belief. As a result, a number of epistemologists sought to resolve the Gettier problem by supplementing JTB with a “No False Grounds” clause along the following lines:

(NFG) S knows that p if and only if (i) p is true, (ii) S believes that p, (iii) S is justified in believing that p, and (iv) S’s justification for p does not rest on any false beliefs.

An analysis of knowledge can be too strong or too weak: It is too strong if it is possible for a person to know that p without satisfying all of the conditions spelled out in the analysis. It is too weak if one can fail to know that p when all the conditions in the analysis have been met. To see that NFG is too strong, we need only modify Gettier’s Case II as follows:

Café

Smith is sitting in a café in Barcelona with Brown having a cup of espresso. While there, with Brown, Smith justifiably infers and comes to believe that J or B on the basis of her justified-but-false belief that Jones owns a Ford [J] and on the basis of her justified-true-belief that Brown is Barcelona [B].

In this scenario, Smith has excellent evidence for B along with her misleading evidence for J. Since Smith knows B is true and validly deduces J or B from her knowledge that B, it is not at all lucky that her justified belief that J or B is true; and so, Smith knows that J or B, despite the fact that part of her evidence, namely, J, is false. Hence, NFG is false, for it entails that a person fails to know that p whenever any part (even a dispensable and thus superfluous part) of her justification is false, when, intuitively, a person with some false evidence for p can still know that p provided she has at least one independent chain of all-true-evidence justification for p.

ii. No Essential False Grounds

In Gettier’s Case II (where Smith clearly fails to know that J or B), Smith’s justification for J or B essentially depends on Smith’s justified-but-false belief that J. In Café (where intuitively Smith does know that J or B), Smith has two independent strands of justification for J or B. The first strand is her justified-but-false belief that J. The second strand is her justified-true-belief that B. As a result, Smith could dispense with the first strand entirely and still be justified in believing the disjunction J or B. Our markedly different appraisals of Smith’s epistemic status vis-à-vis J or B in these two cases suggest that the presence of false grounds precludes the knowledge that p only when those grounds play an indispensable role in a person’s justification for p. Given this insight, it might seem that the no false grounds condition in NFG should be replaced with a no essential false grounds condition as follows:

(NEFG)  S knows that p if and only if (i) p is true, (ii) S believes that p, (iii) S is justified in believing that p, and (iv) S’s justification for p does not essentially depend on any false beliefs.

Unfortunately, NEFG is too weak because there can be all-true-evidence Gettier cases—cases where the person’s justification for her lucky true belief does not depend on any false beliefs. An example of an all-true-evidence Gettier case is provided by Brian Skyrms’s (1967) case involving Sure-Fire matches:

Pyromaniac

Pete knows that Sure-Fire matches have always lit in the past when struck. Pete also knows that the match he is holding is a Sure-Fire match. Based on this evidence, which he knows to be true, Pete justifiably believes that the match he is holding will light when struck [L]. Unbeknownst to Pete, the match he is holding is a defective Sure-Fire match (the first ever!) with impurities that raise its combustion temperature above that which can be produced by striking friction. As luck would have it, just as Pete strikes the match, a sudden burst of Q-radiation ignites the match.

In Pyromaniac, Pete has a justified true belief that L, which is based entirely on true evidence that Pete knows, and yet, it is still just a matter of luck that his belief is true. This example shows that one can have a lucky true belief that p that falls short of knowledge, even when all of one’s evidence for p is true. Thus, NEFG is too weak. There are genuine Gettier cases that it fails to rule out.

iii. Defeasibility Approaches

In each of Gettier’s original cases, there is a true proposition unbeknownst to Smith such that were that proposition added to the rest of Smith’s evidence, Smith would no longer be justified in believing the Gettiered belief. Call such a proposition a defeater. In Case I, the defeater is the true proposition that Nelson will not get the job [~N]. If ~N were added to Smith’s evidence, Smith would not be justified in believing that the person who will get the job has ten coins in her pocket, for she would no longer have any idea who will get the job. In Case II, the defeater is the true proposition that Jones does not own a Ford [~J]. Since Smith has no knowledge as to Brown’s whereabouts, if ~J were added to Smith’s evidence, she would no longer be justified in believing that J or B. Notice, however, that in the case of Café (where Smith is with Brown in Barcelona), the true proposition ~J is not a defeater, because adding ~J to Smith’s evidence in Café would not prevent Smith from being justified in believing that J or B. Smith would still be justified in believing J or B on the basis of her justified true belief that B.

Defeasibility theorists contend that a person fails to know that p whenever there is a defeater for her justification for p. Their proposal for solving the Gettier problem is to supplement the JTB-analysis with a No Defeaters condition as follows:

(ND)    S knows that p if and only if (i) p is true, (ii) S believes that p, (iii) S is justified in believing that p, and (iv) there are no defeaters for S’s justification for p.

The biggest problem facing the No Defeaters approach is that there is no agreement among defeasibility theorists themselves as to the correct account of defeaters. For example, Roderick Chisholm (1964) and Peter Klein (1971) have characterized defeaters as follows:

(D1)     When evidence e justifies S in believing that p, then proposition d is a defeater for S’s justification if and only if (i) d is true and (ii) the conjunction of d and e does not justify S in believing that p.

Keith Lehrer and Thomas Paxson Jr. (1969) contend that D1 is too weak, as a definition of defeaters, because it counts as defeaters certain statements that intuitively are not defeaters. They offer the following case in point:

Grabit

While at the library, I see a student of mine, Tom Grabit, take a book from the shelf, conceal it under his coat, and leave the library without checking it out. I know Tom Grabit well, and I am sure that he stole the book. I justifiedly believe that Tom Grabit stole the book, and he did.

Intuitively, I know that Tom Grabit stole the book. But here’s the rub: Unbeknownst to me, Tom Grabit’s mother said that on the day in question Tom was not in the library, indeed, he was thousands of miles away, and that Tom’s identical twin, John Grabit, was in the library. On the D1 account of defeaters, the following true proposition is a defeater for my justification for thinking that Tom stole the book:

(M) Tom’s mother said that Tom was not in the library at the time of the theft, but his identical twin John was.

If M were added to my evidence, I would no longer be justified in believing that Tom stole the book. This result might seem like the right result until we discover that Tom’s mother is both delusional and a pathological liar, that she said these things to herself in her padded cell, that John Grabit is a figment of her demented mind, and that Tom stole the book just as I thought. Lehrer and Paxson argue that the fact that it is true that a delusional mental patient uttered false statements about Tom Grabit’s location on the day of the theft should not defeat my knowledge that Tom Stole the book. They conclude that the Chisholm/Klein account of defeaters should be replaced with the follow account:

(D2)     When evidence e justifies S in believing that p, then proposition d is a defeater for S’s justification if and only if (i) d is true, (ii) S is completely justified in believing that d is false, and (iii) the conjunction of d and e does not justify S in believing that p.

In Grabit, I do not have any evidence concerning what Tom’s mother said or didn’t say, and so, I am not completely justified in believing that it is false that she said those things. As a result, condition (ii) of D2 is not satisfied, and so, on the Lehrer/Paxson account of defeaters that fact that Ms. Grabit said those things is not a defeater for my evidence that Tom stole the book. Consequently, on the D2-account of defeaters, I have an undefeated justified true belief that Tom stole the book and thus know that Tom stole the book, which is the intuitively correct result.

The Chisholm/Klein D1-account of defeaters gets the Grabit case wrong, for it entails that the true statement M defeats my justification for thinking that Tom stole the book. Since M is a defeater on the Chisholm/Klein account, their account entails that I do not know that Tom stole the book; when, intuitively, I do know that Tom stole the book. I saw him steal it, and the insane ramblings of his demented mother do nothing to undermine my knowledge.

Now consider a different case:

Locked

John Lock is compulsive when it comes to locking his doors. This morning when he left for work, he locked the front door and tripled checked that the door was locked. It is now 11:00 a.m., and John is sitting in his office recalling his morning ritual. He clearly and distinctly remembers locking his front door and triple checking to make sure that it was in fact locked. On the basis of this vivid memorial evidence e, he comes to believe that his front door is locked. Lucy Lock, John’s wife, is notoriously unreliable about locking the doors when she leaves home, which is why John always insists on leaving home after Lucy leaves for work. Unbeknownst to John, Lucy forgot her workout clothes and returned home at 10:30 a.m. to retrieve them, and she just happened to lock the door when she left five minutes later.

So, at 11:00 a.m., John’s belief that the front door is locked is true. Presumably, John does not know that the front door is locked. He thinks the door is locked because he remembers locking it, but that is not why it is locked. It is locked because Lucy absentmindedly and uncharacteristically happened to lock it on her way out. Intuitively, John’s knowledge is defeated by the following true proposition:

(U) The door was unlocked by Lucy at 10:30 a.m.

If U were added to John’s memorial evidence e, John would no longer be justified in believing that his front door is locked. On the Chisholm/Klein D1-account of defeaters, U is a defeater because U is true and the conjunction of U and e would not justify John in believing that his front door is locked. However, on the Lehrer/Paxson D2-account of defeaters, U would not count as a defeater because sitting in his office at 11:00 a.m., John has no evidence concerning whether or not his wife returned home to retrieve her gym clothes, and so, he is not completely justified in believing it false that the door was unlocked by Lucy Lock at 10:30 a.m. Since U is not a defeater on the Lehrer/Paxson account, their account entails that John knows that his front door is locked; when, intuitively, he fails to know that his door is locked, because it is just a matter of luck that Lucy absentmindedly locked it when she left.

The problem for the No Defeaters approach, then, is this: D1 is too weak of an account of defeaters, and as a result, employing a D1-account of defeaters in ND would make ND too strong an account of knowledge; whereas D2 is too strong an account of defeaters, and so, employing it in ND would make ND too weak. Absent an adequate account of defeaters, the No Defeaters approach fails to provide a solution to the problem of epistemic luck.

iv. The Externalist Turn

Externalist theories of justification maintain that epistemic justification is (at least) partly a function of features external to the cognizer, that is, features outside the cognizer’s ken. For example, one prominent externalist theory, process reliabilism, makes a belief’s justificatory status a function of the actual reliability (rather than the perceived reliability) of the process producing that belief. One motivation behind externalism with respect to justification is its unique ability to provide a truth connection that conceptually links justification with truth. To appreciate the importance of this motivation, recall that the role of the justification condition in the JTB-analysis is to rule out lucky guesses as instances of knowledge. In order for justification to be able to properly play that role, there must be some sort of internal connection between justification and truth that makes the former objectively indicative of the latter. Indeed, many epistemologists insist that it is precisely its internal connection to truth that distinguishes epistemic justification from moral and pragmatic justification. To be objectively indicative of truth, justification must be conceptually connected (not merely coincidentally or contingently connected) with truth. In order for there to be a conceptual connection between justification and truth, the following condition must hold: In every possible world W, if conditions C make belief b justified in W, then conditions C also make b objectively probable in W. The rationale for requiring such a truth connection is this: If there were no conceptual connection between justification and truth, it would be just as much a matter of luck when a justified belief turned out to be true as when an unjustified belief turned out to be true. Moreover, a better justified belief would be no more likely to be true than a much less well justified belief, for without a truth connection, no amount of justification is an objective indication of truth.

Unlike externalist theories of justification, no internalist theory of justification can provide the desired conceptual connection between justification and truth. Internalist theories maintain that epistemic justification is solely a function of states internal to the cognizer, such as perceptual states, belief states, memorial seemings, and introspective states. Examples of such theories include classical foundationalism, coherentism, and evidentialism. That no internalist theory of justification can provide a truth connection can be demonstrated as follows: Every internalist theory of justification maintains that the conditions that make a belief justified are entirely specifiable in terms of states internal to the cognizer, and for any set of entirely internally specifiable justification-conferring conditions, C_I, there will always be a possible world, W_D, where a Cartesian evil demon has seen to it that S possesses the requisite internal states and, hence, satisfies C_I, even though all of S’s contingent empirical beliefs are false. Since the conditions C_I that make S’s belief b internalistically justified in W_D­­ do not make b objectively probable in W_D, no internalist theory is capable of providing a truth connection. Because internalistic justification is not conceptually connected to truth, one can easily be internalistically justified in holding a false belief, which can in turn be used to justifiably infer some other belief that may coincidentally turn out to be true. Consequently, employing an internalistic justification condition in the JTB-analysis makes JTB particularly susceptible to Gettier cases.

At first glance, externalistic justification looks more promising as a means of preventing luck from playing a role in the acquisition of true belief, for some externalist theories of justification do provide a conceptual connection between justification and truth. Consider, for example, the following simplified version of process reliabilism:

(PR)     S’s belief b is justified in world W if and only if S’s belief b is produced by a belief-forming cognitive process [BCP] that is W-reliable (where a W­-reliable BCP is a process that tends to produce beliefs in W that are true in W).

Since PR asserts that a belief is justified in W if and only if it is produced by a W-reliable BCP, and since, by definition, the beliefs produced by a W-reliable process tend to be true in W, PR-justified beliefs have a high objective probability of being true. Because reliably-produced, externalistically-justified beliefs are objectively likely to be true, one might think that replacing the internalistic justification condition in the traditional JTB-analysis with an externalistic justification condition would render JTB immune to Gettier-style counterexamples. William Harper (1996) quickly dispels any such notion, with the following counterexample:

Falcon

Smith believes that Jones owns a Ford. Smith was with Jones when Jones purchased her Pinto; Smith has seen the official title to the car in Jones’s name; Jones is a reliable informant that has never deceived anyone; and just this morning, Jones gave Smith a ride to work in her Pinto. Smith has a reliably-produced and reliably-sustained belief that Jones owns a Ford. It is now 1:00 p.m. Unbeknownst to Smith, at noon Jones’s Pinto was vaporized by a terrorist bomb; but, also unbeknownst to Smith, exactly at noon Jones won a Ford Falcon in the State Lottery. Hence, Smith has a reliably-formed true belief that Jones owns a Ford, but her belief is not knowledge.

While internalistic justification may be particularly susceptible to being undermined by Gettier-style knowledge-destroying luck, Harper’s counterexample shows that the Gettier problem plagues all fallibilistic theories of justification, both internalistic and externalistic alike. Whatever virtues externalistic justification might have, solving the Gettier problem is not among them.

v. The Causal Theory of Knowing

In his early work, Alvin Goldman (1967) offers a different diagnosis of what has gone wrong in Gettier cases. In Case II, what makes J or B true is the fact that Brown is in Barcelona, but this fact plays no causal role in Smith’s coming to believe that J or B. In Case I, what makes P (P = the person who will get the job has ten coins in her pocket) true is the number of coins in Smith’s pocket, but this fact plays no role in Smith’s coming to believe P. What causes Smith to believe P is the fact that Nelson has ten coins in her pocket, and this latter fact is not what makes P true. Goldman observes that in these cases there is no causal connection between the Gettiered belief and the fact that makes it true. It is the absence of such a connection that allows for the possibility of belief’s being true purely by luck. Goldman concludes that the traditional JTB-analysis should be replaced with the following causal theory of knowledge:

(CTOK)  S knows that p if and only if the fact that p is causally connected in an appropriate way with S’s believing that p.

The appropriate knowledge-producing causal processes that Goldman identifies include: (i) perception, (ii) memory, (iii) inferentially reconstructed causal chains, each inference of which is warranted, and (iv) combinations of (i)-(iii). The causal theory correctly handles all of the cases we have considered so far. We have already seen how it handles Gettier’s original cases. In Café, what makes J or B true is the fact that Brown is in Barcelona, and that fact is appropriately causally connected with Smith’s believing that J or B, because Smith is having an espresso with Brown in Barcelona. Accordingly, CTOK correctly entails that, in Café, Smith knows that J or B. In Grabit, I see Tom steal the book. Tom’s stealing the book in plain eyesight perceptually causes me to believe that he did, and so, once again, CTOK yields the right result: I know that Tom Grabit stole the book. In Locked, what makes it true that the front door is locked is the fact that Lucy locked it, and this fact plays no causal role in John’s believing his front door is locked. In this case, CTOK correctly entails that John does not know that his front door is locked. He’s just lucky that Lucy happened to lock it. Finally, in Falcon, what makes it true that Jones owns a Ford is the fact that she just won a Ford Falcon in the state lottery, and that fact plays no causal role in Smith’s believing that Jones owns a Ford, and so, Smith fails to know that Jones owns a Ford.

Despite its success in handling these cases, the causal theory falls prey to the following counterexample:

Fake Barn County

An eccentric farmer in Minnesota owns all of the land in Fake Barn County. Wanting to appear much richer than he is, this farmer has erected fake barns all throughout the county. From the road, these fake barns look exactly like real barns, when, in reality, they are just two dimensional barn façades. While nearly every barn-looking structure in the county is a fake, there are a few real barns interspersed among the myriad fakes. Henry, who is driving through Fake Barn County, has no idea that there are any fake barns in the county. Looking out the window of his car, Henry sees what looks to be a barn on the hill just up the road and comes to believe that there is a barn on the hill. Purely by chance, Henry happens to be looking at one of the few real barns in the county.

Intuitively, Henry does not know that there is a barn on the hill. He is just lucky to be looking at one of the few real barns in the county. The lucky nature of his present belief becomes even more obvious once we discover that Henry has been forming barn beliefs ever since entering Fake Barn County, and all of these other barn beliefs have been false. Henry has consistently been duped by the façades.

The causal theory fails because it cannot account for Henry’s lack of knowledge in this case. Henry is now looking at one of the few real barns in the county, and this real barn is what is causing him to believe that there is a barn on the hill. Since Henry’s true belief that there is a barn on that hill is appropriately caused via perception by that very barn on that hill, the causal theory mistakenly entails that Henry knows there is a barn on that hill, when clearly he does not.

e. Controversial Cases

As analyses of knowledge aimed as at solving the Gettier problem have grown in sophistication and complexity, so have the purported counterexamples aimed at refuting these analyses. Some of these purported counterexamples are sufficiently complex and controversial that there is no consensus among epistemologists as to whether or not the person in the example knows the proposition in question. Two such cases are discussed below.

i. Beneficial Falsehoods

Although the no essential false grounds approach was largely abandoned once it was shown that there can be all-true-evidence Gettier cases—cases where S’s justification for her lucky belief p does not depend on any false beliefs—there has remained nearly universal agreement among epistemologists that a person fails to know that p if her justification for p essentially depends on a false belief. Peter Klein (2008) is a noteworthy exception. He contends that there can be beneficial falsehoods—falsehoods essential to one’s justification that nevertheless give one knowledge. Here is one example that Klein offers in support of his controversial view:

Appointment

Based on memory, I believe that my secretary told me on Friday that I have an appointment with a student on Monday. Based on that justified-but-false memorial belief, I come to justifiedly believe that I have an appointment on Monday. As it turns out, I do have that appointment on Monday, and my secretary did tell me of the appointment. However, he didn’t tell me on Friday. He told me on Thursday.

Klein contends that I know that I have an appointment on Monday [A], even though my belief that A essentially depends on my false belief that my secretary told me on Friday about my Monday appointment. It might seem that the false belief that my secretary told me on Friday that I have a Monday appointment is not essential to my justification for A, because if I “remember” that my secretary told me on Friday of my Monday appointment, then presumably I also actually remember that my secretary told me I have an appointment on Monday, and this latter belief is true. But suppose that the secretary was out with the flu the first three days of the week, and also suppose that I do not remember being on campus on Thursday. In fact, I’m confident that I wasn’t on campus on Thursday, having totally forgotten that I briefly stopped in on Thursday to get my mail. Klein contends that in such a situation I would not believe that my secretary told me of the appointment at all, unless I believed that he told me this on Friday. Klein contends that I know that A, even though that belief essentially depends on my false belief that my secretary told me on Friday about my Monday appointment.

What distinguishes beneficial falsehoods from knowledge-destroying falsehoods? Under what circumstances does a false belief f allow S to acquire knowledge that p? Klein’s answers to these questions are rooted in and flow out of his preferred theory of knowledge. Klein contends that knowledge requires both propositional and doxastic justification. Proposition p is propositionally justified for S if and only if S has an epistemically adequate basis for p. S’s belief that p is doxastically justified for S if and only if S’s belief that p has an appropriate causal basis. The basic idea is that in order for S to know that p, S’s belief that p must be epistemically justified and appropriately caused. Armed with the distinction between propositional and doxastic justification, Klein argues that a false belief f is a beneficial falsehood just in case the following seven conditions are met: (i) f is false, (ii) S’s belief that f is doxastically justified (that is, S’s belief that f has an appropriate causal pedigree), (iii) the belief that f is essential in the causal production of the belief that p, (iv) f propositionally justifies p, (v) f entails a true proposition t, (vi) t propositionally justifies p, and (vii) whatever doxastically justifies S in believing that f also propositionally justifies t for S. When these conditions are met, Klein contends that the false belief f is “close enough to the truth” to give one knowledge that p. Applied to the case at hand, F is the false proposition that my secretary told me on Friday that I have an appointment on Monday, and T is the true proposition that my secretary told me that I have an appointment on Monday. Klein contends that my belief that F meets all the conditions for being a beneficial falsehood: (i) F is false, (ii) my belief that F is doxastically justified (appropriately caused) by the fact that he did tell me, (iii) my belief that F is essential to my believing that A (for if I didn’t believe F, I would not believe he had told me about an appointment at all and so I would not believe A), (iv) F propositionally justifies A, (v) F entails the true proposition T, (vi) T propositionally justifies A, and (vii) the fact that my secretary told me on Thursday about my Monday appointment propositionally justifies T for me.

Klein contends that, in the case at hand, it doesn’t really matter what day my secretary told me that I have an appointment on Monday. What matters is the fact that he told me. The false belief that he told me on Friday is close enough to the true proposition that he told me as to give me knowledge that I have an appointment on Monday.

While interesting and provocative, Klein’s case is difficult to assess because it depends on controversial assumptions about belief individuation. Is it possible, for example, to believe that my secretary told me on Friday that I have an appointment on Monday [F], without also believing that my secretary told me that I have an appointment on Monday [T]? If not, then rather than providing us with a case of an indispensable knowledge-generating false belief, Klein may have simply given us another case of justificatory over-determination; for if it is impossible to believe F without also believing T, then there seem to be two independent strands of justification only one of which depends on a false belief, in which case Appointment is simply an analogue of Café above.

ii. Misleading Evidence One Does Not Possess

Gilbert Harman (1973) contends that S’s knowledge that p can be undermined by readily available misleading evidence that S does not possess. In Harman cases, despite the fact that the undermining evidence is misleading, if S were to possess it, S would no longer be justified in believing that p. The idea behind Harman cases seems to be this: Since the misleading evidence is readily available, it is just a matter of luck that S does not possess that evidence, and since luck is incompatible with knowledge, S fails to know that p. Here is one of Harman’s cases:

Assassination

A political leader is assassinated. His associates, fearing a coup, decide to pretend that the bullet hit someone else. On Nationwide television they announce that an assassination attempt has failed to kill the leader but has killed a secret service man by mistake. However, before the announcement is made, an enterprising reporter on the scene telephones the real story to his newspaper, which has included the story in its final edition. Jill buys a copy of that paper, reads the story of the assassination, and believes that the President has been assassinated based on the story. What she reads is true, and so are her assumptions about how the story came to be in the paper. (1973, 143)

Harman insists that Jill does not know that the President has been assassinated. He finds it highly implausible that Jill should know simply because she lacks evidence that everyone else possesses. Harman’s diagnosis is that Jill’s knowledge is undermined by readily available evidence – the misleading televised retraction – that she does not possess.

Epistemologists who have reflected on Harman’s Assassination case remain divided over whether or not Jill knows that the President has been assassinated. Those who think that she does know that the President has been assassinated tend to focus on the facts that (i) all of her evidence is true, (ii) she knows her evidence is true, and (iii) the evidence she has is an accurate indicator of the President’s assassination.

Those epistemologists who think that Jill does not know that the President has been assassinated do not focus on the quality of Jill’s evidence, which is impeccable. Rather, they focus on the lucky nature of her evidence. If Jill had turned on the TV when she got home, like she usually does, she would have seen the televised retraction, and she would have found herself in the same epistemic predicament as everyone else. Given the conflicting reports, she would not have known what to believe. Clearly, Jill is lucky to be in the evidential situation she is in. Since luck is generally thought to be incompatible with knowledge, these epistemologists conclude that Jill fails to know that the President has been assassinated.

iii. Impact of These Cases

Controversial cases like these make the challenge of providing an accurate analysis of knowledge even more difficult. If Jill does know that the President has been assassinated, then all those theories of knowledge that imply that she lacks such knowledge (including Harman’s own theory) are mistaken. On the other hand, if Jill does not know that the President has been assassinated, then all those theories that imply she does are mistaken. Similarly, if I do not know that I have an appointment on Monday, then all those theories that imply I do (including Klein’s theory) are mistaken. If I do know that I have an appointment on Monday, then all those theories that imply I lack such knowledge are mistaken. The competing intuitions these cases engender make the already difficult task of arriving at a mutually agreed upon account of knowledge even more formidable.

f. Where Things Stand

While various proponents of the above proposals might still embrace them, the general consensus is that none of the above attempts at eliminating epistemic luck succeeds. One problem with these first attempts at resolving the Gettier problem is that they tended to emerge in a piecemeal fashion as responses to specific counterexamples, only to fall prey to more elaborate counterexamples themselves. What seems to be needed is a better understanding of epistemic luck itself. If we can get clear on the exact nature of knowledge-destroying luck, we might be in a better position to formulate a condition that can eliminate it. The next section will examine a number of attempts at clarifying the nature of knowledge-destroying luck and will assess several modal conditions that have been proposed to eliminate such luck.

2. The Paradox of Epistemic Luck

In addition to generating problems for those epistemologists seeking an analysis of knowledge, the phenomenon of epistemic luck gives rise to an epistemological paradox in its own right. The paradox is generated by the following three theses: the knowledge thesis, the incompatibility thesis, and the ubiquity thesis. The paradox arises because each of these theses is antecedently plausible, but together they form an inconsistent triad. Each thesis is discussed below.

a. The Knowledge Thesis

According to the knowledge thesis, we possess a great deal of knowledge about the world around us. Commonsense tells us that the knowledge thesis is true. For example, I know that I am in a coffee shop. I know that I am drinking a cup of coffee. I know that I am wearing a blue shirt. I know that I am typing on a laptop computer. And I know that the person sitting next to me is talking on his cell phone at an inappropriate volume. You know that you have eyes. You know that you are reading an IEP article on epistemic luck. You know that the article you are reading is written in English. Together, we know a lot. At least, we think we do, until we encounter a skeptical paradox like the paradox of epistemic luck.

b. The Incompatibility Thesis (Again)

The incompatibility thesis is the thesis that epistemic luck simpliciter is incompatible with knowledge. As noted above, there has been nearly universal agreement among epistemologists that knowledge is incompatible with epistemic luck. The post-Gettier literature is replete with evermore-sophisticated counterexamples to the array of purported accounts of knowledge proffered in an effort to resolve the Gettier problem. The standard formula for generating a counterexample to a purported analysis of knowledge is to conjure up a case where, despite satisfying all the conditions in the analysis, it is still just a matter of luck that the person’s belief that p is true. The element of luck involved is ipso facto thought to prevent the belief from being an instance of knowledge. The nearly unanimous acceptance of such examples illustrates just how widespread commitment to the incompatibility thesis is.

c. The Ubiquity Thesis

Epistemic luck is an all-pervasive phenomenon that infects every fallibilistic epistemology in one form or other. Its inescapability can be demonstrated as follows: To convert true belief to knowledge, every viable fallibilistic epistemology requires satisfying either some internalistic justification condition or some externalistic condition (that may or may not be a justification condition). But neither an internalistic nor an externalistic condition can completely succeed in eliminating epistemic luck. A little recognized consequence of the new evil demon problem is that internalistic justification is not conceptually connected to truth in any robust way, for demon-world victims have internalistically justified beliefs almost all of which are false. Given the absence of a robust truth connection, it is always in some sense a matter of luck when a merely internalistically justified belief turns out to be true. To see why, consider my twin in an evil demon world W_D. By hypothesis, he has the same beliefs that I have, he has the same memorial seemings that I have, he possesses the same experiential evidence that I possess, and he goes through exactly the same internal reflections that I do. In short, our internal cognitive lives are phenomenologically, doxastically, and reflectively indistinguishable. Consequently, if I satisfy the internal conditions for justifiedness (whatever they may be), then my demon-world twin satisfies them as well, and so, we are both internalistically justified in our beliefs. If, on the other hand, I fail to satisfy those conditions, then my twin also fails to satisfy them, and so neither of us is internalistically justified in our beliefs. Now assume the former scenario where both of us are internalistically justified in our beliefs. The only relevant difference between my twin and me is that he is being systematically deceived, whereas, as epistemic good fortune would have it, I am not. If he and I were to change places, there would be no introspectable difference, and each of us would continue to believe as we do, only now I would be the hapless victim of demon deception. Clearly, I am epistemically fortunate to be in the world I am in (assuming I am in the world I take myself to be in) and not in W_D. Since I am lucky to be in the world I am in, there is a clear sense in which it is epistemically lucky that my internalistically justified beliefs are true. My twin is not nearly so lucky, for, thanks to the demon, all of his internalistically justified beliefs are false. Since these results can be generated no matter which internalistic theory of justification one employs, it is always a matter of luck when a merely internalistically justified belief happens to be true.

Truth-connected externalist approaches (for example, reliabilist, truth-tracking, and safety-based accounts) avoid this kind of epistemic luck. However, they are subject to another kind of ineliminable epistemic luck. Recall, from section 1, the externalistic process-reliabilist account of epistemic justification:

(PR)     S’s belief b is justified in world W if and only if S’s belief b is produced by a belief-forming cognitive process that is W-reliable.

Call a belief that is justified in virtue of being reliably produced a PR-justified belief. Although it is not typically a matter of luck when a PR-justified belief turns out to be true (since PR-justification is conceptually connected to truth), it is a matter of luck when a belief turns out to be PR-justified. To see why, consider, once again, my twin in the demon world W_D. By hypothesis, he and I share the same beliefs, possess the same evidence, go through the same internal reflections, and have phenomenologically, doxastically, and reflectively indistinguishable cognitive lives. Even so, our beliefs do not have the same PR-justificatory status. His beliefs are not PR-justified, because they are produced by processes that the demon has rendered unreliable in W_D, whereas my beliefs are PR-justified because they are produced by processes that are reliable in the actual world (Again, I’m assuming, for the sake of the example, that the actual world is the world we think it is.). According to PR, it is not a matter of luck that my beliefs are true and his beliefs are false, because my beliefs are PR-justified and his are not, and PR-justified beliefs have a high objective probability of being true. What is a matter of luck is the fact that my beliefs are PR-justified and his are not. After all, we both take ourselves to be in non-demon-manipulated worlds, and we both take ourselves to have reliably-produced PR-justified beliefs. As luck and ill luck, respectively, would have it, I am correct and he is incorrect. Since there is no introspectively discernible difference between our worlds, given what each of us has to go on, there is a clear sense in which I could have just as easily been mistaken and been the one with demon-rendered-unreliable processes. Compared to my twin, I am epistemically fortunate to be in a non-demon world where my cognitive faculties are reliable. Since I am epistemically lucky (compared with my twin) to be in a world where I have reliable cognitive processes, there is clearly a sense in which it is just a matter of luck that I have PR-justified beliefs.

Analogous considerations can be applied to any externalistic constraint on knowledge. Consider the externalistic condition of being a safe belief (to be explained below). While a safe belief’s being true is not epistemically lucky, having safe beliefs is epistemically lucky, for in a demon world none of one’s beliefs are safe. Since every fallibilistic epistemology incorporates either an internalistic justification condition or an externalistic condition, no fallibilistic epistemology can rid us of epistemic luck’s intractable presence.

d. The Skeptical Challenge

Epistemic luck, then, is ubiquitous and unavoidable. If all forms of epistemic luck are incompatible with knowledge, as the incompatibility thesis maintains, skepticism is correct and the knowledge thesis is false. And yet, we remain convinced that we possess lots of knowledge. The task facing the anti-skeptical epistemologist is to reconcile the rather strong intuition that epistemic luck is not compatible with knowledge with the equally evident observation that it must be. Since the ubiquity thesis is unassailable, the anti-skeptical epistemologist must reject the incompatibility thesis.

e. Rejecting the Incompatibility Thesis

Peter Unger (1968) was the first epistemologist to note that not all forms of epistemic luck are incompatible with knowledge. He identified the following three types of benign epistemic luck: (1) Propositional luck: It can be entirely accidental that p is true, and S can still know that p. For example, a person who witnesses an automobile accident can certainly know that the accident occurred. (2) Existential luck: For S to know that p, S must exist, and it might be extraordinarily lucky that S exists. If S is the lone survivor of a fiery plane crash, S is lucky to be alive, but S’s existential luck does not preclude her from knowing that she survived the crash. (3) Facultative luck: To know that p, S must possess the cognitive skills requisite for knowledge. Suppose S is shot in the head but the bullet narrowly misses all vital regions of the brain required for conceptual thought and knowledge. S is overwhelmingly lucky that she still possesses the cognitive capacities needed for knowledge, but since she does possess them, she is still capable of knowing many things, including that she was shot in the head.

f. Knowledge-Destroying Epistemic Luck

Unger has successfully identified three types of harmless epistemic luck, but not all forms of epistemic luck are benign. What is needed is an account of knowledge-undermining luck.

i. Evidential vs. Veritic Luck

Mylan Engel Jr. (1992) distinguishes two kinds of epistemic luck, evidential luck and veritic luck, and argues that only the latter is incompatible with knowledge. Engel characterizes these two types of luck as follows:

(EL)     A person S is evidentially lucky in believing that p in circumstances C if and only if it is just a matter of luck that S has the evidence e for p that she does, but given her evidence e, it is not a matter of luck that her belief that p is true in C.

(VL)    A person S is veritically lucky in believing that p in circumstances C if and only if, given S’s evidence for p, it is just a matter of luck that S’s belief that p is true in C.

To see that evidential luck is compatible with knowledge, suppose that a bank robber’s mask slips momentarily during a holdup and the startled teller sees clearly that the robber is the bank president. In such a situation, the teller would clearly be lucky to have the evidence she does, but she would nevertheless know that the bank president is the villain.

Engel argues that all genuine Gettier cases involve veritic luck. In Gettier’s Case II presented above, Smith’s belief that J or B is veritically lucky: Given Smith’s misleading evidence of Jones’s Ford-ownership status and her total lack of evidence concerning Brown’s whereabouts, it is just a matter of luck that Smith’s belief that J or B is true. Veritic luck with respect to p is incompatible with knowing that p, because it undercuts the connection between S’s evidence for p and the truth of p in a way that makes it entirely coincidental from S’s point of view that p is true.

Engel then uses the distinction between evidential and veritic luck to assess Harman cases. Jill is not veritically lucky in believing that the President has been assassinated, for she has accurate, reliable evidence concerning the assassination in the form of a reputable newspaper’s column, and given this evidence, it is not a matter of luck that her belief is true. However, Jill is evidentially lucky—she is lucky to be in the evidential situation that she is in, for had she turned on the TV and seen the fabricated retraction, she would have been in a much worse evidential situation vis-à-vis the President’s assassination. Lucky for her, she did not turn on the TV Like the bank teller above, Jill is lucky to have the evidence she does, but given her evidence, she is not lucky that her belief is true. Having argued that only veritic luck is incompatible with knowledge, Engel concludes that Jill does know the President has been assassinated. If Engel is right, then Harman cases do not provide examples of knowledge-undermining luck.

ii. Justification-Oriented Luck

Hamid Vahid (2001) maintains that there are two types of knowledge-destroying epistemic luck. He agrees with Engel that veritic luck as characterized by VL is incompatible with knowledge, but he argues, contra Engel, that there is a kind of evidential luck (which he dubs ‘justification-oriented luck’) that is also incompatible with knowledge. Vahid contends that knowledge-precluding justification-oriented luck is a function of how easily a person’s belief could have been unjustified:

(JL)      A person suffers from knowledge-precluding justification-oriented luck, when she is justified in believing that p, but given her epistemic circumstances, she could have easily been unjustified in holding that very belief.

Vahid contends that Harman’s Assassination case provides an example of knowledge-precluding justification-oriented luck. Jill could have easily been unjustified in believing that the President was assassinated. Had she turned on the TV like she usually does, she would not have been justified in holding that belief. Vahid concludes that Jill does not know that the President was assassinated—her knowledge is destroyed by justification-oriented luck.

While JL might yield the right result in Harman’s Assassination case, it seems to yield the wrong result with respect to the bank teller case. The teller is justified in believing that the bank president is the robber because she just happened to look up during the brief moment when his mask had slipped and clearly saw the robber’s face, but she could have easily been unjustified in this belief. Had she continued to look in her cash drawer while nervously collecting the cash for the robber, she would not have seen the robber’s face. Clearly, the teller knows that the bank president is the robber, and yet, JL implies that she lacks such knowledge.

iii. Modal Veritic Luck

Duncan Pritchard (2003) agrees that, of these types of luck, only veritic luck is incompatible with knowledge, but he replaces Engel’s evidence-based characterization of veritic luck with the following modal analysis:

(MVL)  For all agents S and propositions p, the truth of S’s belief that p is veritically lucky if and only if S’s belief that p is true in the actual world a but false in nearly all nearby possible worlds in which S forms the belief in the same manner as in a.

MVL differs from VL in the following way: it concerns the connection between the method of belief formation and proposition believed, rather than the connection between S’s evidence and the proposition for which it is evidence. Pritchard argues that a safety-based neo-Moorean account, according to which knowledge is safe true belief, is capable of eliminating veritic luck. In a moment, we will see, contra Pritchard, that safe true belief is incapable of ruling out certain paradigm cases of veritic luck.

g. Second-Wave Anti-Luck Epistemologies

The post-Gettier literature is rife with attempts at supplementing or amending the traditional JTB-analysis with a satisfactory anti-luck constraint on knowledge. As surveyed in Section 1, the first wave of proposals included adding a no-false-grounds or no-essential-false-grounds condition to JTB, supplementing JTB with a defeasibility condition, incorporating an externalistic justification condition in JTB, and replacing JTB with a causal theory of knowing. These and similar proposals have fallen prey to ever-more-complicated Gettier-style examples. The general consensus is that none of these proposals succeeds. Second-wave luck-eliminating proposals invoke counterfactual or subjunctive constraints on knowing, principal among them: sensitivity and safety. Let us consider each of these proposals in turn.

i. Sensitivity

S’s belief that p is sensitive to p’s truth-value if and only if S would not believe that p if p were false (that is, if and only if S does not believe p in any of the closest ~p-worlds). To be sure, sensitive belief does preclude veritic luck, but it does so at a steep price. First, the sensitive-true-belief account of knowledge results in closure failure. Second, there are compelling reasons to think that knowledge does not require sensitivity. Let’s examine each cost in turn.

Most epistemologists regard it as all but axiomatic that we can expand our knowledge by competently deducing some currently unknown proposition u from some other known proposition k whenever we know that k entails u. This widely-embraced idea is codified in the principle of epistemic closure which has been formulated in each of the following ways:

(PEC1)   If S knows that p and S knows that p entails q, then S knows (or is in a position to know) that q.

(PEC2)   If (i) S knows that p, (ii) S knows that p entails q, (iii) S competently deduces q from her knowledge that p and that p entails q, and (iv) S comes to believe q as a result of that competent deduction, then S knows that q.

One reason the principle of epistemic closure has enjoyed such widespread endorsement is this: If I know that p and know that p entails q and I deduce and come to believe q from that knowledge, my belief that q could not be false (because knowledge is factive and the truth of p entails q, together with the truth of p, guarantees the truth of q).

The following example illustrates why sensitive-true-belief accounts of knowledge result in closure failure. I currently believe that I am in a coffee shop [C]. My belief that C is sensitive. If I were not in a coffee shop, I would not believe that I was, for if I were not in a coffee shop, I would be somewhere else, for example, the grocery store or my office, and would not mistakenly think that I was at a coffee shop. Since my belief that C is sensitive (that is, I would not believe it if it were false), the sensitive-true-belief account of knowledge entails that I know that C. I also currently believe that I am not at home in bed having a lifelike dream of being in a coffee shop [~H], but my belief that ~H is not sensitive, for if I were at home in bed having a lifelike dream of being in a coffee shop (that is, if ~H were false), I would still believe that ~H. So, according to the sensitive-true-belief account, I do not know that ~H. Of course, my being at the coffee shop entails that I am not at home in bed dreaming that I am in a coffee shop (that is, C ==> ~H), and I know that C ==> ~H. The sensitive-true-belief account results in closure failure because it entails that I know that C and know that C ==> ~H, but I do not know (and cannot come to know) that ~H on that basis.

Most epistemologists regard the principle of epistemic closure to be so plausible that they find any theory of knowledge that results in closure failure deeply problematic if not outright absurd. In fairness to sensitivity theorists, they recognize that their theories entail closure failure and acknowledge the antecedent implausibility of closure failure, but they argue that, despite its counterintuitiveness, there are principled reasons for thinking that knowledge is not closed under known implication. They grant that we have all sorts of ordinary knowledge, but insist that we do not know and cannot know that the skeptic’s hypotheses are false. Thus, they embrace closure failure because they think that it accurately captures our actual epistemic situation. Perhaps sensitivity theorists are right, but given how widely accepted the principle of epistemic closure is, it would be preferable to identify an anti-luck constraint that avoids closure failure.

The second major problem facing the sensitivity proposal, as Jonathan Vogel (1999) shows with Hole-In-One, is that knowledge does not require sensitivity. The fourth hole at Augusta National Golf Course where The Masters is played is a tricky 240-yard par 3, euphemistically called “Flowering Crabapple.” In 2007, not one player shot a hole-in-one on this diabolical hole, and there were only eleven birdies throughout four rounds of play. Right now, I know that not all seventy-two players in this year’s Masters will shoot a hole-in-one on Flowering Crabapple in the first round of play, but my belief to this effect is not sensitive. Were every golfer to shoot a hole-in-one on Flowering Crabapple in Round One of the Masters in defiance of the astronomical odds against it, I would still believe that they were not going to do so. So, sensitivity is not necessary for knowledge.

ii. Safety

Considerations such as these have led a number of epistemologists (Sosa 1999 & 2000, Williamson 2000a & 2000b, Pritchard 2005) to replace the sensitivity condition with some sort of safety condition. Safety comes in different strengths: S’s true belief that p is strongly safe if and only if were S to believe that p, p would be true (that is, in all the closest worlds where S believes p, p is true). S’s true belief that p is weakly safe if and only if S would not easily be mistaken with respect to p (that is, in the overwhelming majority of nearby worlds where S believes that p, p is true).

Peter Murphy (2005) employs Saul Kripke’s famous counterexample to sensitivity to show that strong safety results in closure failure. Suppose the following is true of Fake Barn County: The landscape is peppered with barn façades, there are a few real barns in the county, some of the real barns are red and some are blue, but all of the façades are red. Driving through Fake Barn County, Mary is unaware that the most of the barn-looking structures are façades. She looks at a blue barn and comes to believe that she is looking at a blue barn. Her belief is safe. In all nearby worlds where she believes she is looking at a blue barn, she is looking at a blue barn, for there are no blue façades. However, her belief that she is looking at a barn is not safe. There are many nearby worlds where she believes she’s looking at a barn, but is really just looking at a façade. So, strong safety entails that Mary knows she’s looking at a blue barn, but does not know she’s looking at a barn.

Weak safety is open to a different worry. If knowledge only requires weakly-safe justified true belief, then a person who justifiably believes her lottery ticket will lose knows that her ticket will lose (unless, of course, it happens to win), because in the overwhelming majority of nearby worlds, her ticket is a loser. Many epistemologists (though not all) insist that people do not know their lottery tickets will lose, prior to hearing the announced results. Anyone convinced that people do not know their tickets will lose, before learning of the results, will think that weak safety is too weak of an anti-luck constraint on knowledge.

Avram Hiller and Ram Neta (2007) convincingly argue that no safe belief condition can eliminate all cases of veritic luck as follows: Start with a justified-but-false-and-unsafe belief like Smith’s belief that Jones owns a Ford. Next, have Smith justifiably infer a disjunction of the form J or ~G, where Smith has no evidence whatsoever that ~G is true and where unbeknownst to Smith, ~G is true in all nearby worlds. Let ~G = Brown will not win a Grammy. Suppose that, unbeknownst to Smith, Brown is totally devoid of musical talent and there is no remotely close world where Brown wins a Grammy. Then, Smith’s true belief that J or ~G will be safe, but veritically lucky nonetheless, because given Smith’s evidence, it is just a matter of luck that J or ~G is true. Since the safe-true-belief account cannot rule out all cases of veritic luck, safe-true-belief is not sufficient for knowledge.

Hiller and Neta’s example also shows that Pritchard’s modal account of veritic luck [MVL] is not the correct analysis of veritic luck. Smith’s belief that J or ~G is clearly veritically lucky: Smith bases her belief that J or ~G on her justified-but-false-and-unsafe-belief that Jones owns a Ford. Since Smith has absolutely no knowledge or evidence of Brown’s total lack of musical talent, given Smith’s evidence, it is just a matter of luck that her belief that J or ~G is true. But MVL entails that Smith’s belief is not veritically lucky. According to MVL, a belief is veritically lucky if it is true in the actual world but false in nearly all nearby worlds where Smith forms the belief in the same manner. In Hiller and Neta’s case, Smith’s belief that J or ~G is true in the actual world, but it is also true in all nearby worlds where it is formed in the same way (because ~G is true in all nearby worlds). Thus, according to MVL, Smith’s belief that J or ~G is not veritically lucky. Since Smith’s belief is veritically lucky, the MVL analysis of veritic luck is mistaken.

h. Paradox Lost

The paradox of epistemic luck dissolves once we recognize that the incompatibility thesis is false. Not all forms of epistemic luck are incompatible with knowledge. Certainly propositional, existential, and facultative luck are compatible with knowledge, and at least some forms of evidential luck, like the evidential luck had by the bank teller above, are also compatible with knowledge. There is growing consensus that veritic luck is the principal form of knowledge-destroying luck. Since veritic luck is far from ubiquitous, the incompatibility of veritic luck with knowledge poses no general threat to the possibility of knowledge. One can know that p whenever it is not a matter of veritic luck that one’s justified belief that p is true.

3. Epistemic Luck and Knowing that One Knows

Although there remains broad disagreement over how exactly to formulate the condition needed to rule out knowledge-destroying epistemic luck in a theory of knowledge, there is widespread consensus that whatever the correct condition is, S does not need to know that that condition has been met in order to know that p. The point can be illustrated as follows: Let the expression “S is not Gettiered with respect to p” serve as a placeholder for whatever the correct substantive luck-eliminating condition is. If we add this condition to the traditional justified-true-belief analysis, we get the following schema for analyzing knowledge:

(K) S knows that p if and only if:

(i) p is true,

(ii) S believes that p,

(iii) S is justified in believing that p, and

(iv) S is not Gettiered with respect to p.

According to (K), S does not need to know that conditions (i)-(iv) are met in order to know that p. All that (K) requires for S to know that p is that conditions (i)-(iv) be met. Since S need not know or even believe that she is not Gettiered with respect to p in order to know that p, the possibility of Gettier-style, knowledge-destroying, veritic luck poses no special obstacle to first-order knowledge (where ‘first-order knowledge’ refers to knowing that p and ‘second-order knowledge’ refers to knowing that one knows that p). As long as S is not veritically lucky with respect to p, she will know that p, according to schema (K), provided she has a justified true belief that p.

The situation seems to be quite different when it comes to knowing that one knows, for one of the most natural ways of coming to know that one knows that p is by knowing that one has met the conditions required for knowing that p, and knowing the latter requires knowing that one is not Gettiered with respect to p. The burden of the present section is to examine whether the phenomenon of knowledge-destroying epistemic luck undermines more reflective forms of knowledge, such as, knowing that one knows.

a. Internalism, Epistemic Luck, and the Problem of Knowing that One Knows

Arch internalist H.A. Pritchard (1950) famously remarked: “We must recognize that whenever we know something we either do, or at least can, by reflecting, directly know that we are knowing it.” Other internalists have been less sanguine about the prospects of second-order knowledge. For example, Roderick Chisholm (1986) argues that one cannot generally know that one knows on the grounds that one cannot generally know whether or not one’s evidence for p is defeated by Gettier considerations. Is Chisholm right? Does the Gettier problem pose special—indeed, generally insurmountable—obstacles to internalistically knowing that one internalistically knows that p? Richard Feldman (1981) does not think so. He thinks that the Gettier problem poses a minor obstacle to second-order knowledge, but one that can be easily overcome with minimal intellectual effort. Mylan Engel Jr. (2000) disagrees. Siding with Chisholm, Engel argues that the Gettier problem poses three distinct challenges to second-order knowledge, which, when taken together, threaten to undermine the possibility of knowing that one knows. Michael Roth (1990) contends that the Gettier problem poses no threat to second-order knowledge whatsoever. To assess these competing views, it will be helpful to have a clearer idea of just what is required for internalistic knowledge.

Post-Gettier internalists with respect to knowledge tend to work within the JTB+ tradition in that they maintain that, in addition to true belief, knowledge requires internalistic justification as well as some fourth externalistic anti-luck condition to rule out Gettier cases. Accordingly, by replacing condition (iii) in schema (K) above with an explicitly internalistic justification condition, we arrive at a schema for internalistic knowledge that most internalists would readily embrace:

(K_i)      S internalistically knows (knows_i) that p if and only if:

(k1) p is true,

(k2) S believes that p,

(k3) S is internalistically justified (justified_i) in believing that p, and

(k4) S is not Gettiered with respect to p.

Since (K_i) provides a perfectly general account of knowledge_i, we can arrive at the conditions for second-order knowledge_i simply by substituting S knows_i that p for p in schema (K_i):

(K_iK_i) S knows_i that S knows_i that p if and only if:

(kk1) S knows_i that p is true,

(kk2) S believes that S knows_i that p,

(kk3) S is justified_i in believing that S knows_i that p, and

(kk4) S is not Gettiered with respect to S knows_i that p.

Chisholm doubts that (kk3) can be satisfied. To appreciate Chisholm’s worry, consider one of the most natural and straightforward ways of satisfying condition (kk3), namely, being justified_i in believing that one has met all of the conditions required for knowing_i that p:

(J_iK_ip)    S is justified_i­­ in believing that S knows_i that p if and only if:

(jk1) S is justified_i­­ in believing that p,

(jk2) S is justified_i­­ in believing that S believes that p,

(jk3) S is justified_i­­ in believing that S is justified_i in believing that p, and

(jk4) S is justified_i­­ in believing that S is not Gettiered with respect to p.

Since (jk1) is identical to (k3), (jk1) is satisfied whenever S knows_i that p; and if we assume both doxastic and justificational_i transparency (that is, if we assume that we have introspective access to what we believe and to our justification_i for what we believe), as do many internalists, then (jk2) and (jk3) also pose no special problems for the would-be second-order knower.

Chisholm’s concern is with (jk4). He contends that we cannot typically tell whether or not our evidence for p is defeated by Gettier considerations. Based on this contention, Chisholm argues as follows: Let S be any one of us and let p be a proposition that S knows_i. Since S cannot tell whether S’s evidence for p is defeated by Gettier considerations, S is not justified_i in believing that S is not Gettiered with respect to p. Hence, (jk4) is not satisfied. Since (jk4) is not satisfied, S is not justified_i­ in believing that S knows_i that p, that is, (kk3) is not satisfied. Since (kk3) is a necessary condition for knowing_i that one knows_i that p, S does not know_i­ that S knows_i that p. The gist of Chisholm’s argument is this: Since we are not justified_i in believing that we are not Gettiered with respect to p, we do not know_i that we know_i that p.

Feldman disagrees. He thinks that, with minimal effort, a person who knows_i that p can be justified_i in believing that she is not Gettiered with respect to p. Feldman offers two reasons for thinking that it is relatively easy to be justified_i in believing that one’s evidence for p is not defective and thus that one is not Gettiered with respect to p. Since Feldman is primarily concerned with determining when a person who knows_i that p knows_i that she knows_i that p, he assumes that S has first-order knowledge_i that p when presenting his reasons.

No False Evidence

Assume that S knows_i that p. S’s knowing_i that p entails that S is justified_i in believing that p. Since S is justified_i in believing that p, S is also justified­_i­ in believing that all of her evidence for p is true. Since false evidence is usually what makes one’s evidence defective, S is justified_i­ in believing that her justification_i for p is not defective and thus that she is not Gettiered with respect to p.

Induction

Since S has very rarely found herself to be the victim of Gettier-type situations, she is justified_i in believing that such situations are very rare and atypical. Given their rarity and atypicality, S is justified_i in believing that she is not is such a situation with respect to p.

Feldman contends that No False Evidence and Induction provide S with good internalistic reasons for believing that she is not Gettiered with respect to p. Since internalistic justification is a function of having good internalistic reasons and S has good internalistic reasons for believing that she is not Gettiered with respect to p, S is justified_i in believing that she is not Gettiered with respect to p, that is, (jk4) is satisfied. Since (jk1)-(jk3) are also easily satisfiable, with minimal intellectual effort, S can be justified_i in believing that she knows_i that p. Feldman concludes that satisfying (kk3) poses no special obstacle to knowing_i that one knows_i.

Engel contends that the Gettier problem generates three distinct challenges for the would-be second-order knower—challenges that threaten to undermine the satisfaction of (kk1), (kk3), and (kk4), respectively:

(1) First-order actual Gettierization: One way the Gettier problem can preclude S from knowing_i that she knows_i that p is by preventing S from knowing_i that p. If S is Gettiered with respect to p, then S fails to know_i that p, and thus, she fails to know_i that she knows_i­ that p, since (kk1) is unsatisfied. However, since first-order actual Gettierization precludes second-order knowledge_i only when it obtains, it poses no greater threat to second-order knowledge_i than it poses to first-order knowledge_i.

(2) First-order possible (but non-actual) Gettierization: While actual first-order Gettierization, when it obtains, undermines second-order knowledge_i by falsifying (kk1), possible (but non-actual) first-order Gettierization threatens to thwart one of the most natural ways of satisfying (kk3), namely, satisfying conditions (jk1)-(jk4) of J_iK_ip. Like Chisholm, Engel’s concern here is with (jk4). He argues that the reasons Feldman offers—No False Evidence and Induction—do not provide adequate reasons for thinking that one is not Gettiered with respect to p. No False Evidence is not a good reason to think that one has not been Gettiered with respect to p because, as noted in Section 1, there can be all-true-evidence Gettier cases, a point that Feldman himself demonstrated in an earlier article (Feldman, 1974). While No False Evidence may provide S with a reason for thinking that she is not the victim of a Gettier case involving a justified-false-belief, it provides her with no reason to think that she is not the victim of an all-true-evidence Gettier case. The problem with Induction is that many of the Gettier cases described in the literature are what we might call “invisible” Gettier cases, that is, they are cases such that, were they to obtain, the Gettier victim would never find out. They are cases that look and feel like knowledge and pass away unnoticed. Unless Pyromaniac Pete is wearing a Geiger counter, he will never discover that it was Q-radiation and not striking friction that caused his defective Sure Fire match to light. Unless John Lock interrogates Lucy Lock about her morning routine, he will likely never discover that she unlocked the doors to their house at 10:30 a.m. Unless Henry leaves the highway and investigates, he will likely never discover that most of the barn-looking structures are façades. Considerations such as these make it plausible to think that invisible Gettier cases are more likely to be the norm than visible Gettier cases. The fact that S has rarely found herself to be Gettiered in the past may provider her with a reason for thinking that visible Gettier cases are rare, but it provides her no reason to think that invisible Gettier cases are rare, and without such a reason, she is not justified­_i in believing that she is not being (invisibly) Gettiered with respect to p. Engel concludes that it is much more difficult to be justified_i in believing that one is not Gettiered with respect to p than Feldman alleges.

(3) Meta-Gettierization: Engel dubs second-order Gettierization “meta-Gettierization.” Just as first-order Gettierization occurs when S’s justification for p is defective in a way that makes S veritically lucky with respect to p, meta-Gettierization occurs when S’s justification for believing that S knows_i that p is defective in a way that makes S veritically lucky with respect to S knows_i that p. By way of illustration, Engel asks us to consider Professor Cleaver, a fictitious philosophy professor from the 1950s, who, as a pre-Gettier epistemologist, justifiably accepts the JTB-analysis of knowledge. Since Cleaver is justified_i in believing that knowledge_i is justified_i true belief, he is justified_i in believing that (jk1)-(jk3) are jointly sufficient for being justified_i in believing that one knows_i that p. Since he is justified_i in believing that (jk1)-(jk3) are jointly sufficient for being justified_i in believing that one knows_i that p, he is justified_i in believing that he knows_i that p provided that he is justified_i in believing that he has justified_i-true-belief that p. Let p be a proposition that Cleaver knows_i. If he believes that he knows_i that p, and if he is justified_i in believing that he knows_i that p on the basis of his justified_i-but-false-belief that knowledge_i is justified_i true belief, together with his justified_i-true-belief that he has a justified_i-true-belief that p, then Cleaver will have a justified_i-true-belief that he knows_i that p, which falls short of knowledge_i because his justification_i essentially depends on his justified_i-but-false-belief that knowledge_i is justified_i true belief. The point generalizes. Anytime that Cleaver comes to believe that he knows_i that p on the basis of his justified_i-but-false-belief that the JTB-analysis is correct, he will automatically be meta-Gettierized and will, thus, fail to know_i that he knows_i that p. Engel then argues that whether those of us who have grown up in the post-Gettier enlightenment can avoid Cleaver’s fate depends on whether any of us justifiedly­_i believes a true epistemology. Since no epistemology to date is immune to objection, Engel thinks it doubtful that any of us holds a true epistemology (no matter how well justified_i we might be in our preferred epistemology). Given how likely it is that we are operating with a false epistemology, Engel contends that whenever we come to believe that we know_i that p on the basis of our preferred epistemology, we are almost certain to become yet another meta-Gettier casualty, for we are almost certain to have based our belief that we ­­know_i that p on a justified_i false belief about the requirements for knowledge_i.

Roth contends that the debate over whether the Gettier problem poses a major or minor obstacle to second-order knowledge_i is entirely misguided. He argues that Gettier considerations pose no obstacle to second-order knowledge_i whatsoever. His argument is rooted in what he calls the Fallibilist Assumption Governing Empirical Knowledge:

(FA)    For every proposition of the form Kp (where p is empirical and K is the knowledge operator), there are certain contingencies such that: (i) their obtaining is physically possible, (ii) were they to obtain, Kp would be false, and (iii) S is completely justified in disregarding any of these contingencies in considering whether she has adequate justification for p.

Roth contends that there are two types of Kp-falsifying contingencies. “Type I contingencies” satisfy conditions (i), (ii), and (iii) of (FA). “Type II contingencies” satisfy conditions (i) and (ii), but not (iii). Roth asks us to imagine a great dividing wall – The Wall of Fallibilism – that separates the Type I contingencies from the Type II contingencies. As Roth envisions it, the Wall of Fallibilism plays an important role in protecting us from knowledge-destroying epistemic luck. If, given S’s evidence for p in circumstances C, it is simply a matter of luck that p is true in C, then S does not know that p in C. To ensure that it is not just a matter of veritic luck that S’s belief that p is true (in C), S must be suitably protected from error with respect to p (in C). According to Roth, the Wall protects us from the slings and arrows of outrageous Type I error possibilities by cordoning us off from these remote properly ignorable Kp-falsifying contingencies. We do not need evidence that these contingencies do not obtain in order to know_i that p. Being safely outside the Wall, we do not need to take them into account in our epistemic reflections at all. Their sheer remoteness and improbability protects us from having to worry about them. As long as they do not actually obtain, these contingencies provide no obstacle to knowledge_i whatsoever. But the Wall does not provide us with all the protection from luck and error that we need in order to possess knowledge_i. We must also be protected from error with respect to those Type II contingencies that are inside the Wall. These p-falsifying contingencies are genuinely in doubt. Were any of these contingencies to obtain, p would be false, and as a result, so too would Kp. To protect us from these realistic non-ignorable ~p-possibilities, we need justification that precludes them. The picture of fallible knowledge_i that emerges is this:

S knows_i that p only if (i) S’s justification_i is strong enough to rule out all of the relevant Type II ~p-possibilities inside the Wall and (ii) none of the Type I contingencies outside the Wall obtain.

Roth thinks that the Wall metaphor explains why Gettier considerations pose no obstacle to second-order knowledge_i­­. Gettier considerations are paradigm cases of Type I contingencies. We do not need to know_i or even believe that Type I contingencies do not obtain in order to know_i that p. As long as no Type I contingencies obtain, S will know_i that p provided she satisfies the other conditions required for knowing_i that p. Like Type I contingencies generally, Gettier considerations only undermine knowledge_i when they obtain. We do not need to know_i or even believe that no Gettier circumstances obtain in order to know_i that p. As long as they do not obtain, we will know_i that p provided we have met the other conditions required for knowing_i that p. Since Gettier contingencies are outside the Wall, Roth contends that it is perfectly proper to ignore them when trying to determine whether one knows_i that p.

Roth’s reason for thinking that Gettier contingencies pose no obstacle to knowing_i that one knows_i is that he thinks that Gettier possibilities are properly ignorable Type I contingencies that lie safely outside the Wall. The problem with Roth’s argument is that the Wall’s location is not fixed. As Roth himself admits, where the Wall is situated is relativized to a particular attempt to acquire knowledge_i of a particular proposition. Which contingencies are outside the Wall and which are not, that is, which contingencies are properly ignorable and which are not, is a function of the proposition one is attempting to come to know_i and the circumstances under which one is trying to come to know_i it. While Gettier contingencies vis-à-vis p are clearly properly ignorable where coming to know_i that p is concerned, they are not properly-ignorable when it comes to knowing_i that Kp. To the contrary, it seems that Kp-destroying Gettier contingencies are precisely the kind of contingencies that one needs to be able to rule out in order to know that one knows that p. Gettier contingencies are not p-falsifying contingencies (for p is true in Gettier situations), but they are Kp-falsifying contingencies. As such, they are Type I contingencies when it comes to knowing_i that p, but Type II contingencies when it comes to knowing_i that one knows_i that p. In effect, the Wall moves outward where second-order knowledge_i is concerned. The very same Gettier contingencies that are outside the p-Wall are inside the Kp-Wall. Being inside the Kp-Wall, they are not properly ignorable when it comes to knowing_i that Kp. To know_i that one knows_i that p, one must know_i that no Gettier Kp-falsifying contingencies obtain. It is precisely because we cannot generally know_i that no Gettier contingencies obtain that Chisholm and Engel contend that second-order knowledge_i is difficult to attain.

b. Epistemic Luck and Reflective Knowledge

Even if veritic luck poses no special problem for reflectively knowing that one knows, Duncan Pritchard contends that another more worrisome kind of epistemic luck does preclude such knowledge. Reflective epistemic luck arises when, from the agent’s reflective position, it is just a matter of luck that her belief is true. More precisely:

MRL   For all S and p, the truth of S’s belief that p is reflectively lucky if and only if S’s belief that p is true in the actual world but, in nearly all nearby possible worlds consistent with what S is able to know by reflection alone, were S to believe p, p would be false.

When it comes to modal reflective luck, the epistemically relevant possible worlds are ordered in a non-standard way solely in terms of what the agent is able to know on the basis of her subjective internal reflections alone. Accordingly, any possible world consistent with S’s having that same internally accessible evidence that she has in the actual world will be reflectively equally close to the actual world. Since, by hypothesis, S would have exactly the same internally accessible evidence in a demon world or a BIV-world that she has in the actual world, these worlds are just as close, reflectively, to the actual world as is the world where everything is just as it seems. Since our ordinary commonsense perceptual beliefs are false in a wide variety of these reflectively equally close skeptical-scenario possible worlds, Pritchard maintains that MRL entails that our ordinary commonsense perceptual beliefs—if true in the actual world—are reflectively lucky. [Whether MRL actually entails that all of our true commonsense perceptual beliefs are reflectively lucky is by no means obvious. The fact that our commonsense beliefs are false in malevolent demon and BIV worlds does not show that these beliefs are false in nearly all reflectively equally close possible worlds. After all, for every malevolent demon world where we are systematically deceived, there is a corresponding benevolent demon world that is just as close, reflectively, in which the benevolent demon sees to it that all of our commonsense beliefs are true.]

Pritchard thinks that reflective luck is not incompatible with ordinary knowledge (he thinks only veritic luck is), but he insists that reflective luck is incompatible with a much-desired internalistic kind of robust reflective knowledge. Pritchard contends that skeptical challenges force us to confront the fundamental human epistemic predicament, to wit, that we cannot know, on the basis of reflection alone, that the skeptic’s radical hypotheses are false. For example, he thinks that we cannot know, by reflection alone, that we are not bodiless brains being kept alive in vats of nutrient being deceived into thinking we have hands.

If Pritchard is right that we lack reflective knowledge that the skeptic’s hypotheses are false, then those who think that reflective knowledge is closed under known entailment face an even greater skeptical threat. According to the principle of epistemic closure (PEC1): If S knows that p and also knows that p entails q, then S either knows or is in a position to know that q. Since we know that having hands entails not being a deceived bodiless brain in a vat, if we cannot have reflective knowledge that we are not deceived bodiless brains in vats, then given PEC1, we cannot have reflective knowledge that we have hands. The point can, of course, be generalized. Since radical skeptical hypotheses are incompatible with virtually all of the ordinary propositions we routinely take ourselves to know, if we lack reflective knowledge that radical skeptical hypotheses are false, then we lack reflective knowledge of the most mundane of ordinary propositions.

Pritchard contends that skeptical challenges force us to recognize the reflectively lucky nature of our anti-skeptical beliefs and that this, in turn, explains the enduring epistemic angst that skeptical hypotheses engender. Pritchard argues that the ineliminability of reflective luck shows that we not only lack reflective knowledge that the skeptic’s hypotheses are false, we also lack reflective knowledge that our ordinary commonsense beliefs are true. If Pritchard is right, we may, indeed, possess a great deal of ordinary knowledge, but the ineliminability of reflective luck will forever preclude us from reflectively being able to tell that we do.

4. Conclusion

Reflecting on the nature and scope of epistemic luck gives us deeper insight into the nature and scope of knowledge. Gettier cases demonstrate that fallible justification is not capable of ruling out all forms of knowledge-destroying epistemic luck and that thus knowledge requires more than justified true belief. Just what anti-luck condition must be added justified true belief to arrive at an adequate analysis of knowledge remains an open question.

Recognizing which forms of epistemic luck are incompatible with knowledge and which are not puts us one step closer to identifying the correct luck-eliminating condition. It is now generally acknowledged that veritic luck is incompatible with knowledge. Whether other forms of epistemic luck, such as, justification-oriented luck, are incompatible with knowledge is a question that deserves more attention. At a minimum, any adequate theory of knowledge must be capable of ruling out all cases of veritic luck and to date no theory has been able to do so.

The possibility of knowledge-destroying veritic luck poses no special skeptical threat where first-order knowledge is concerned. As long as a person is not veritically lucky with respect to p, she will know that p, provided she has met the other conditions required for knowledge. The situation appears to be different where second-order knowledge is concerned. While there is no consensus to date as to how serious an obstacle the Gettier problem poses for second-order knowledge, it poses enough of an obstacle to such knowledge to render implausible the once widely held KK-thesis according to which knowing entails knowing that one knows.

Veritic luck is not the only form of epistemic luck that threatens more reflective forms of knowledge. Reflective luck also threatens to undermine the possibility of reflectively knowing that one knows. Our apparent inability to know, on the basis of reflection alone, that the skeptic’s radical hypotheses are false, together with the principle of  epistemic closure, threatens to undermine the possibility of reflective knowledge altogether.

5. References and Further Reading

• Chisholm, Roderick. 1986. “The Place of Epistemic Justification.” Philosophical Topics 14: 85-92.
  • Argues that one cannot generally know that one knows on the grounds that one cannot generally know whether or not one’s evidence for p is defeated by Gettier considerations.
• Chisholm, Roderick. 1964. “The Ethics of Requirement.” American Philosophical Quarterly 1: 147-153.
  • Provides a No Defeaters response to the Gettier problem.
• Clarke, Michael. 1963. “Knowledge and Grounds: A Comment on Mr. Gettier’s Paper.” Analysis XXIV: 46-48.
  • Argues that No False Grounds is mistaken since S can derive a justified true belief that p from a justified true belief that q and still fail to know that p because S’s grounds for q are false. Contends that knowledge is “fully grounded” justified true belief, where in order to be fully grounded, the chain of reasons leading up to S’s proximate grounds for p must itself contain no false grounds at any point in the chain.
• Coffman, E.J. 2007. “Thinking about Luck.” Synthese 158: 385-398.
  • Defends a lack of control account of luck.
• Dretske, Fred. 1971. “Conclusive Reasons.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 49: 1-22.
  • Argues that in order to rule out knowledge-destroying luck, one’s reasons for p must be conclusive in the sense that one would not have had those reasons if p were false.
• Engel Jr., Mylan. 2000. “Internalism, the Gettier Problem, and Metaepistemological Skepticism.” Grazer Philosophische Studien 60: 99-117.
  • Argues that the Gettier problem poses three distinct challenges to second-order knowledge which, when taken together, threaten to undermine the possibility of knowing that one knows.
• Engel Jr., Mylan. 1992. “Is Epistemic Luck Compatible with Knowledge?” Southern Journal of Philosophy 30: 59-75.
  • Identifies veritic luck as the principal form of knowledge-destroying luck. Distinguishes veritic luck from evidential luck. Argues that, of these two types of luck, only veritic luck is incompatible with knowledge. Further argues that only externalist epistemologies are capable of ruling out veritic luck.
• Feldman, Richard. 1981. “Fallibilism and Knowing that One Knows.” Philosophical Review XC: 266-282.
  • Defends the iterative KK-thesis. Argues that the Gettier problem poses a minor, but hardly insurmountable, obstacle to second-order knowledge.
• Feldman, Richard. 1974. “An Alleged Defect in Gettier Counterexamples.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 52: 68-69.
  • Provides a decisive example of an all-true-evidence Gettier case that shows that No False Grounds is too weak.
• Fumerton, Richard. 1995. Metaepistemology and Skepticism. Lanham, MA: Rowman and Littlefield Publishers.
  • Argues that second-order knowledge is too easy on externalistic accounts of knowledge and that, therefore, such accounts fail to capture the kind of knowledge that interests us.
• Gettier, Edmund. 1963. “Is Justified True Belief Knowledge?” Analysis 23: 121-3.
  • Demonstrates that justified true belief is not sufficient for knowledge. Highlights two paradigm examples of knowledge-destroying epistemic luck.
• Greco, John. 2004. “A Different Sort of Contextualism. Erkenntnis 61: 383-400.
  • Defends a contextualist virtue epistemology. Offers a situationalist account of veritic luck, that is, an account tied to one’s epistemic situation rather than to one’s evidence: S is veritically lucky in believing that p if and only if, given S’s epistemic situation, it is just a matter of luck that S’s belief that p is true.
• Greco, John. 2003. “Virtue and Luck, Epistemic and Otherwise.” Metaphilosophy 34: 353-366.
  • Defends a virtue theoretic solution to the Gettier problem. Argues that when S has a true belief that p because S believes out of intellectual virtue (that is, when S’s believing out of intellectual virtue is what accounts for her have a true belief that p rather than a false belief or no belief), then S’s true belief that p is not veritically lucky.
• Goldman, Alvin. 1979. “What Is Justified Belief?” In Justification and Knowledge. Ed. George Pappas. Dordrecht, Holland: D. Reidel Publishing Company.
  • Develops and defends an externalistic, process reliabilist account of justified belief.
• Goldman, Alvin. 1967. “A Causal Theory of Knowing.” The Journal of Philosophy 64: 355-372.
  • Attempts to solve the Gettier problem by replacing the traditional justification condition with a causal constraint requiring that one’s belief that p be caused by the fact that makes p true.
• Harman, Gilbert. 1973. Thought. Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
  • Presents three much-discussed examples intended to show that knowledge can be undermined by readily available misleading evidence that one does not possess. Defends a No Essential False Grounds response to the Gettier problem.
• Harper, William. 1996. “Knowledge and Luck.” Southern Journal of Philosophy 34: 273-283.
  • Demonstrates that the Gettier problem plagues all fallibilistic theories of justification, both internalistic and externalistic alike. Argues that in addition to the traditional justification, truth, and belief conditions, an adequate analysis of knowledge must incorporate a “no luck” condition.
• Heller, Mark. 1999. “The Proper Role for Contextualism in an Anti-Luck Epistemology.” Philosophical Perspectives, 13, Epistemology: 115-29.
  • Proposes a context-sensitive modal account of epistemic luck according to which ‘S’s belief that p is epistemically lucky’ is true if and only if there is at least one world (in a contextually-determined set of epistemically relevant worlds) where S’s belief that p is false. Defends a contextualist anti-luck epistemology which maintains that ‘S knows that p’ is true if and only if there is no world (in a contextually-determined set of epistemically relevant worlds) where S’s belief that p is false.
• Hetherington, Stephen. 2005. “Gettier Problems.” Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
  • Canvasses various purported solutions to the Gettier problem. Concludes with the contentious suggestion that justified true belief is sufficient for knowledge and that veritically-lucky justified true beliefs, like those in Gettier’s original examples, are actually cases of knowledge.
• Hiller, Avram and Ram Neta. 2007. “Safety and Epistemic Luck.” Synthese 158: 303-13.
  • Demonstrates that safe true belief is not sufficient for knowledge by providing an example of a veritically lucky safe true belief that clearly falls short of knowledge.
• Klein, Peter. 2008. “Useful False Beliefs.” In Epistemology: New Essays. Ed. Quentin Smith. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Argues that there can be beneficial falsehoods—falsehoods essential to one’s justification—that nevertheless give one knowledge.
• Klein, Peter. 1971. “A Proposed Definition of Propositional Knowledge.” Journal of Philosophy 68: 471-482.
  • Defends a No Defeaters solution to the Gettier problem.
• Lackey, Jennifer. 2007. “Why We Don’t Deserve Credit for Everything We Know.” Synthese 158: 345-361.
  • Argues that knowledge is not credit-worthy true belief and that thus virtue theoretic accounts of knowledge are mistaken.
• Lackey, Jennifer. 2006. “Pritchard’s Epistemic Luck.” The Philosophical Quarterly 56: 284-289.
  • Provides a counterexample to Pritchard’s modal account of luck.
• Lehrer, Keith. 1990. Theory of Knowledge. Boulder, CO: Westview Press.
  • Defends a coherence theory of justification. Argues that knowledge is undefeated justified true acceptance.
• Lehrer, Keith and Thomas Paxson Jr. 1969. “Knowledge: Undefeated Justified True Belief.” The Journal of Philosophy 66: 225-237.
  • Defends an alternative No Defeaters response to the Gettier problem. Introduces the Tom Grabit counterexample to the Chisholm/Klein account of defeaters.
• Lycan, William. 1977. “Evidence One Does Not Possess.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 55: 114-26.
  • Argues that misleading evidence one does not possess does not undermine one’s knowledge and that, thus, Harman Cases are actually cases of knowledge.
• Murphy, Peter. 2005. “Closure Failure for Safety.” Philosophia 33: 331-34.
  • Adapts Kripke’s famous “blue barn” counterexample to Nozick’s analysis of knowledge to show that safe true belief accounts of knowledge also result in closure failure.
• Myers, Robert G. and Kenneth Stern. 1973. “Knowledge without Paradox.” Journal of Philosophy 70: 147-160.
  • Argues that p can justify S in believing some other proposition q only if p is true and that, thus, Gettier’s original cases do not provide examples of justified true beliefs that fall short of knowledge.
• Nozick, Robert. 1981. “Knowledge and Skepticism.” In Philosophical Explanations. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
  • Develops and defends a sensitivity-based subjunctive conditionals analysis of knowledge.
• Plato: Theaetetus in Plato: Collected Dialogues. Eds. E. Hamilton and H. Cairns. Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press, 1961.
• Pritchard, Duncan. 2005. Epistemic Luck. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Proposes a modal account of veritic luck. Argues that safety precludes veritic luck. Defends an externalist neo-Moorean safe true belief account of ordinary knowledge. Concedes to the skeptic that reflective luck is ineliminable and that such luck is incompatible with reflective knowledge.
• Pritchard, Duncan. 2003. “Virtue Epistemology and Epistemic Luck.” Metaphilosophy 34: 106-30.
• Pritchard, H.A. 1950. Knowledge and Perception. Oxford: The Clarendon Press.
• Riggs, Wayne. 2007. “Why Epistemologists Are So Down on their Luck.” Synthese 158: 329-344.
  • Defends a lack of control account of luck. Argues that knowledge is credit-worthy true belief.
• Roth, Michael. 1990. “The Wall and the Shield: K-K Reconsidered.” Philosophical Studies 59: 147-157.
  • Argues that the Gettier problem poses no obstacle to second-order knowledge on the grounds that Gettier-type contingencies lie safely outside the wall of fallibilism and can simply be ignored (unless they actually obtain).
• Russell, Bertrand. 1912. The Problems of Philosophy. Oxford, England: Oxford University Press.
• Skyrms, Brian. 1967. “The Explication of ‘X Knows that p’.” Journal of Philosophy 64: 373-389.
  • Provides one of the first cases of an all true evidence Gettier case.
• Sosa, Ernest. 2007. A Virtue Epistemology: Apt Belief and Reflective Knowledge, Volume 1. Oxford, England: Oxford University Press.
  • Develops and defends a virtue epistemology which maintains that knowledge is reliably-produced safe true belief, the correctness of which is attributable to one’s epistemic competence. Argues that when the correctness of a reliably-produced safe belief is attributable to the proper exercise of an epistemic competence, then the resultant belief is not epistemically lucky.
• Sosa, Ernest. 2000. “Skepticism and Contextualism.” Philosophical Issues, 10, Skepticism: 1-18.
  • Defends a non-contextualist safety-based Moorean response to the skeptical paradox.
• Sosa, Ernest. 1999. “How to Defeat Opposition to Moore.” Philosophical Perspectives, 13, Epistemology: 141-54.
  • Develops a safety-based Moorean response to the skeptical paradox. Argues that such a response is preferable to skeptical, tracking, relevant-alternative, and contextualist accounts.
• Steup, Matthias. 2006. “The Analysis of Knowledge.” Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
  • Discusses the necessary conditions for knowledge. Examines internalistic and externalistic analyses of knowledge.
• Swain, Marshall. 1981. Reasons and Knowledge. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press.
• Truncellito, David A. 2007. “Epistemology,” Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
• Unger, Peter. 1968. “An Analysis of Factual Knowledge.” Journal of Philosophy 65: 157-70.
  • Shows that various forms of epistemic luck – including propositional luck, existential luck, and facultative luck – are compatible with knowledge. Argues that knowledge is non-accidentally true belief.
• Vahid, Hamid. 2001. “Knowledge and Varieties of Epistemic Luck.” Dialectica 55: 351-362.
  • Argues that truth-oriented veritic luck and justification-oriented luck are both incompatible with knowledge.
• Vogel, Jonathan. 1999. “The New Relevant Alternatives Theory.” Philosophical Perspectives, 13, Epistemology: 155-80.
  • Uses Hole-in-One to argue that sensitivity is not necessary for knowledge.
• Williamson, Timothy. 2000a. “Scepticism and Evidence.” Philosophy and Phenomenal Research 60: 613-28.
• Williamson, Timothy. 2000b. Knowledge and Its Limits. Oxford, England: Oxford University Press.
• Zagzebski, Linda. 1996. Virtues of the Mind. Cambridge, England: Cambridge University Press.
  • Characterizes Gettier-style knowledge-destroying luck as cases of “double luck” where epistemic bad luck is cancelled out by epistemic good luck. Argues that no fallibilist epistemology can rule out knowledge-destroying luck. Defends a virtue-based epistemology according to which knowledge is a state of cognitive contact with reality arising out of acts of intellectual virtue, and argues that this definition of knowledge is immune to the Gettier problem because truth is entailed by the other components of the definition.

 

Author Information

Mylan Engel Jr.
Email: mylan-engel@niu.edu
Northern Illinois University
U. S. A.

The Safety Condition for Knowledge

A number of epistemologists have defended a necessary condition for knowledge that has come to be labeled as the “safety” condition. Timothy Williamson, Duncan Pritchard, and Ernest Sosa are the foremost defenders of safety. According to these authors an agent S knows a true proposition P only if S could not easily have falsely believed P. Disagreement arises, however, with respect to how they capture the notion of a safe belief.

Unlike Pritchard and Sosa, who have gone on to incorporate the safety condition into a virtue account of knowledge, Williamson distances himself from the project of offering reductive analyses of knowledge. Williamson’s project can best be thought of as an illumination of the structural features of knowledge by way of safety. The maneuvers of Pritchard and Sosa into the domain of virtue epistemology are not discussed here.

This article is a treatment of the different presentations and defenses of the safety condition for knowledge. Special attention is first paid to an elucidation of the various aspects or features of the safety condition. Following a short demonstration, of the manner in which the safety condition handles some rather tough Gettier-like cases in the literature, some problems facing safety conclude this article.

Table of Contents

1. Historical Background
2. The Safety Condition as a Necessary Condition for Knowledge
   1. Timothy Williamson
   2. Duncan Pritchard
   3. Ernest Sosa
3. Elucidating the Safety Condition
   1. What Counts as a Close World?
      1. The Time Factor
      2. What Type of Reliability does Safety Require?
      3. Methods
      4. Skepticism
   2. How do the Safety and Sensitivity Conditions Differ?
   3. The Semantics of Safety
4. Safety in Action
   1. Gettier and Chisholm
   2. Fake Barns
   3. Matches
5. Problems for Safety
   1. Knowledge of Necessarily True Propositions
   2. Knowledge of the Future
      1. Williamson’s Response
      2. Pritchard’s Response
   3. Safety and Determinism
6. References and Further Reading

1. Historical Background

Knowledge is incompatible with accidentally true belief. That is to say, if an agent S is lucky that her belief P is true, S does not know P. This feature of knowledge was made explicit by Bertrand Russell (1948: 170) and, more famously, by Edmund Gettier (1963) who demonstrated that a justified true belief (JTB) is insufficient for knowledge. Gettier provided us with cases in which there is strong intuitive pull towards the judgment that S can have a justified true belief P yet not know P because S is lucky that S’s belief P is true. To use Russell’s case, suppose S truly believes it’s noon as a result of looking at a clock that correctly reads noon. However, unbeknownst to S this clock broke exactly twelve hours prior. Even though S has good reasons to believe it’s noon and S’s belief is true, S does not know it’s noon since S is lucky that her belief is true.

Several notable attempts were made to improve the JTB analysis of knowledge; in particular, some were attracted to the idea that a stronger justification condition would resolve Gettier problems (Shope 1983: 45-108). Thus began the vast literature on the nature of epistemic justification. Others, though disagreeing among themselves about the place of justification in an account of knowledge, sought a solution to the Gettier problem in a new anti-luck condition for knowledge. (The majority of these accounts dropped the justification requirement.) One of these attempts is particularly relevant here. Fred Dretske (1970) and Robert Nozick (1981) proposed accounts of knowledge central to which were a  counterfactual condition, Nozick’s being the more popular of the two. Nozick proposed the following counterfactual as a necessary condition for knowledge (1981: 179): S knows P via a method M only if, were P false, S would not believe P via M [¬P ☐→ ¬B(P)]. This came to be termed the sensitivity condition for knowledge. To satisfy this condition it must be the case that in the closest world in which P is false S does not believe P. That is, S must track the truth of P to know P (where possible worlds are ordered as per their similarity to the actual world).

Nozick’s account enjoyed widespread popularity because of its anti-skeptical capabilities. Following Nozick, I count as knowing that there is tree in my garden since I would not believe that if none were planted there, that is, in the closest world in which there is no tree in my garden (for example, when none is planted there), I do not believe that there is a tree in my garden. Worlds where radically skeptical scenarios are true count as further off since those worlds are more dissimilar to the actual world than the world in which no tree is planted in my garden. That I would believe falsely in those worlds is thus irrelevant. In other words, that I would falsely believe in such a far off world is inconsequential to whether I believe truly in the actual world.

Nozick’s account came with two significant costs, however. Firstly, it cannot accommodate the very intuitive principle that knowledge is closed under known entailment. Roughly, this principle states that if S knows P and S knows that P entails Q then S knows Q. It follows, then, that if I know that I have hands, and I know that if I have hands entails that I am not a handless brain in the vat, then I know that I am not a handless brain in the vat. However, I fail to know that I am not a handless brain in the vat since I would falsely believe I was not a handless brain in the vat in the closest world in which the proposition “I am not a handless brain in the vat” is false (that is, the world in which I am a handless brain in the vat). In other words, the sensitivity condition for knowledge cannot be satisfied when it comes to the denial of radically skeptical hypotheses. Seeing no way to redeem his account from this problem, Nozick (1981: 198ff) was forced into the rather unorthodox position of having to deny the universal applicability of closure as a feature of knowledge.

Secondly, Nozick admits that the sensitivity condition cannot feature as a condition for knowledge of necessarily true propositions as there is no world in which such propositions are false since, by definition, necessarily true propositions are true in every possible world. The scope of the sensitivity condition is thus limited to knowledge of contingently true propositions. That the sensitivity condition cannot, for example, illuminate the nature of our mathematical or logical knowledge makes it less preferable, ceteris paribus, than a condition that can.

At the end of the twentieth century and the beginning of the twenty-first, several authors proposed a novel and relatively similar condition for knowledge that has come to be known as the safety condition, the elucidation of which being the objective here. As the relevant features of the safety condition are presented and explained, the following salient points will emerge. The safety condition is similar to the sensitivity condition in that it too is a modal condition for knowledge. That’s where any significant similarity ends. As shall be demonstrated at length, safety differs from sensitivity in the following ways. Firstly, and most importantly, safety permits knowing the denial of a radically skeptical hypothesis in a manner that maintains the closure principle. This advantage by itself acts as a strong point in favor of the safety condition. Secondly, most formulations of the safety condition are not in the form of a counterfactual. Thirdly, the safety condition is more expansive than the sensitivity condition in that its scope includes knowledge of both necessarily true and contingently true propositions. Lastly, epistemologists since then generally believe the safety condition opens the way to a more enlightened response to skepticism.

2. The Safety Condition as a Necessary Condition for Knowledge

The literature on the safety condition is challenging for even the seasoned philosopher. Seeing that Williamson, Pritchard, and Sosa have developed their thoughts over a lengthy period of time and in a large number of publications, it has become quite a task to keep track of the epicycles in the conceptual development and defense of the safety condition. Additionally, each of its advocates is motivated to formulate the safety condition in a distinct way, where even slight differences in formulation make for significant conceptual divergence. In light of these considerations, it is best to begin with a separate treatment of each author’s presentation of the safety condition before proceeding to an overall elucidation of the safety condition.

a. Timothy Williamson

Williamson (2000) is involved in the project of illuminating several structural features of knowledge. His safety condition is both the result of this project and an integral part of it.

Williamson, in stark opposition to the standard practice in the post-Gettier period, resists being drawn into offering a conceptual analysis of knowledge in terms of non-trivial and non-circular necessary and jointly sufficient conditions for knowledge, a project he thinks is futile given its history of repetitive failures. Knowledge, for Williamson, requires avoidance of error in similar cases. This is to be taken as a schema by which to elucidate the structural features of knowledge. The basic idea, then, is that S knows P only if S is safe from error; that is, there must be no risk or danger that S believes falsely in a similar case. The relevant modal notions of safety, risk, and danger are cashed out in terms of possible worlds such that there is no close world surrounding the actual world in which S falls into error: “safety is a sort of local necessity” (Williamson 2009d: 14). These possible worlds in which S truly believes P act as a kind of “buffer zone” from error and thereby prevent the type of epistemic luck that characterize Gettier cases. In Russell’s case, for example, S does not know that it’s noon since there is a close world in which S falsely believes that it’s noon, for instance, one in which S looks at the clock slightly before or after noon.

Despite Williamson’s opposition to the project of analyzing knowledge into non-trivial necessary and sufficient conditions, it seems clear enough that Williamson should be read as putting forward safety as a necessary condition for knowledge given that he presents the safety condition as a conditional using the appropriate locution only if. And this is how his critics typically interpret him. As Williamson formulates the safety condition in a number of different ways on different occasions, it is impossible to pin down one formulation as representing Williamson’s view. Here is one formulation that will suffice for the time being:

(SF)     If one knows, one could not easily have been wrong in a similar case (2000: 147)

Nevertheless, the manner in which Williamson expresses the safety condition still separates him from those who offer necessary conditions for knowledge. As Williamson emphasizes time and again, the safety condition, as he states it, is to be taken as a circular necessary condition in that whether or not a case β counts as a relevantly similar case to α is in part determined by whether we are inclined to attribute knowledge to the agent in α; safety (reliability in similar enough cases) cannot be defined without reference to knowledge, and knowledge without reference to safety (2000: 100; 2009d: 9-10). Safety, by Williamson’s lights is thus not to be taken as a recipe by which to determine whether or not the agent is to be attributed knowledge in each and every case. Rather, it is a model by which to illuminate the structural features of knowledge and by which we can begin talking about knowledge in individual cases. As Williamson observes, “the point of the safety conception of knowing is not to enable one to determine whether a knowledge attribution is true in a given case by applying one’s general understanding of safety, without reference to knowing itself. If one tried to do that, one would very likely get it wrong” (2009d: ibid.).

b. Duncan Pritchard

Pritchard is attracted to the idea that a conceptual analysis of our concept “luck” will yield sufficient insight from which to build a satisfactory anti-luck condition for knowledge. In other words, with a conceptual mastery of the nature of luck in hand, the problem of epistemic luck can, in theory, be overcome. Pritchard’s safety condition is thus formulated in a manner which reflects his work on the conceptual analysis of luck.

For Pritchard (2005: 128) an event E counts as lucky for an agent S if and only if E is significant to S and E obtains in the actual world but does not obtain in a wide class of nearby possible worlds in which the relevant initial conditions for that event are the same as in the actual world. For example, one is lucky not to be killed by a sniper’s bullet since in the actual world the bullet misses but it does not miss in the close worlds. Importantly, luck comes in degrees. One naturally counts as lucky if the sniper missed by a meter. But one counts as luckier if the sniper missed by a centimeter. The agent counts as luckier in the latter case, claims Pritchard (2009b: 39), because the world in which one is killed in that case is much closer to the actual world than the world in which one is killed in the former case (since the second sniper is better). Close worlds, then, can be roughly divided into two classes—near and non-near, and are to be weighted accordingly—the near close worlds count for more than the non-near close worlds.

The foregoing analysis of luck motivates the following analysis of epistemic luck: S is very lucky that her belief P is true in the actual world if P is false in at least one of the near close worlds. And S is lucky, but not as lucky, that her belief P is true if P is true in the actual world but false in at least one of the non-near close worlds. Stated otherwise, false belief in a very close world is incompatible with knowledge while false belief in a non-near close world is compatible with knowledge. Here is a formulation of the safety condition by Pritchard (2007, 2008, 2009a) as a non-circular necessary condition in a standard account of knowledge:

(SF*)     S’s belief is safe if and only if in most nearby possible worlds in which S continues to form her belief about the target proposition in the same way as in the actual world, and in all very close nearby possible worlds in which S continues to form her belief about the target proposition in the same way as in the actual world, the belief continues to be true.

That is to say, as long as S truly believes P using the same method in all of the very close worlds and in nearly all of the non-near close worlds, S’s belief P is safe. Accordingly, the agent in Russell’s case fails to know that it’s noon since there is a very close world in which she falsely believes that it’s noon, for example, the very close world in which that clock stops slightly before or after noon.

Pritchard’s focus is knowledge of contingently true propositions. However, Pritchard (2009a: 34) claims that to extend the safety condition to handle knowledge of a necessarily true proposition P, which is true in all possible worlds, his safety condition can easily be augmented in such a way as to require that S not falsely believe a different proposition Q in a very close world and nearly all non-near close worlds using the same method that S used in the actual world.

Of the many ways in which Pritchard’s condition differs from Williamson’s, it is evident that they differ in one very important respect: Pritchard’s condition permits relatively few cases of falsely believing P in non-near close worlds. Pritchard is motivated to make this concession since his safety condition is informed by his account of luck, which counts S lucky vis-à-vis an event E even though E occurs in some non-near close worlds. Williamson’s condition, by contrast, has a zero tolerance policy for false belief in any close world.

c. Ernest Sosa

Sosa arrives at his formulation of the safety condition as a necessary condition for knowledge by way of working through some of the fundamental shortcomings he identifies in Goldman’s relevant alternatives condition and Nozick’s sensitivity condition. As Sosa puts it, both Goldman and Nozick failed to adequately capture the way in which the proposition believed must be modally related to the truth of that proposition. For Sosa, an agent S counts as knowing P only if S believes P by way of a safe method or, in Sosa’s words, a safe “indication” or “deliverance.”

Sosa’s formulation of the safety condition differs from both Williamson’s and Pritchard’s in that it is stipulated in the form of the following counterfactual (1999a: 146):

(SF**)       If S were to believe P, P would be true [B(P) ☐→ P]

The following short note on counterfactuals helps explain the logic of (SF**). Firstly, according to Lewis’s semantics for counterfactuals (1973), a counterfactual of the form P ☐→ Q is true at a world W only if some world in which P and Q are true is closer to W than any world in which P is true but Q false. Since Lewis thinks that the closest world to W is W itself, the counterfactual P → Q is trivially true at W if P and Q are both true at W. Accordingly, when the antecedent of a counterfactual is true, it follows that P & Q entails P ☐→ Q. Nozick (1981: 176, 680 n.8) finds this result untenable and rejects Lewisian semantics for counterfactuals with true antecedents. Sosa concurs with Nozick. On their semantics for counterfactuals with true antecedents, the counterfactual B(P) ☐→ P is true at a world W if and only if S truly believes P by method M in W and in all close worlds in which S believes P by method M, P is true. It follows, then, that like (SF) and unlike (SF*), Sosa’s condition entails zero tolerance for false belief in any close world.

Secondly, though remarkably similar to the sensitivity condition, (SF**) is not logically equivalent to the sensitivity condition [¬P ☐→ ¬B(P)] since contraposition is invalid for counterfactuals. The following example, from Lewis (1973: 35) demonstrates that contraposition (A→B) ↔ (¬B → ¬ A) is invalid for counterfactuals. Consider the following counterfactual: (A) If Boris had gone to the party, then Olga would still have gone. It should be clear that (A) is not equivalent to its contraposition (B) If Olga had not gone to the party then Boris would still not have gone, because althoughwhile (A) is true (B) is false since Boris would have gone had Olga been absent from the party.

In light of these considerations about counterfactuals, Sosa’s formulation of safety explains why the agent in Russell’s case lacks knowledge. Since there is a close world in which he uses the same method as he does in the actual world at a slightly earlier or later time, namely consulting a broken clock, and thereby comes to falsely believe it to be noon, his belief in the actual world is not safe.

Sosa has since moved on from defending a “brute” safety condition as a necessary condition for knowledge. Sosa (2007, 2009) argues that an agent’s belief must be apt and adroit to count as knowledge, where such virtues differ from safety considerations.

3. Elucidating the Safety Condition

The presentation of the safety condition thus far has been intentionally bare-boned for introductory purposes. This section is devoted to spelling out the finer details or characteristics of the condition, which is a rather challenging task given the presence of some vague patches in the safety literature.

It goes without saying that for epistemic purposes possible worlds W₁, …, W_N count as relevantly closer to or further from the world W in which S believes P at time T on a case by case basis relative to most or all of the following factors: the belief P, time T, the agent S, and the method M by which S formed the belief P at T in W. In other words, the conditions of belief formation, represented by the set {S, P, T, M}, play a constitutive, though not exclusive, role in a determination of closeness. (With respect to safety, one can either think of these possible worlds as branching possibilities à la Hawthorne and Lasonen-Aarnio (2009) or as concentric circles surrounding a subject-centered world, as Lewis (1973: 149) does in his semantics for counterfactuals.) It follows, then, that the adequacy of the safety condition will turn on, among other things, how close worlds are to be specified, the time of the belief formation, what type of reliability is at play, and how safety theorists understand methods. A foray into these important questions follows.

a. What Counts as a Close World?

Before attempting to answer this important question, four points must be made. Firstly, to satisfy the safety condition it is not the case that in every close world the agent must truly believe the relevant proposition; that is to say, S can safely believe P in W even though there are close worlds in which the agent does not form the belief P, for example, where S does not believe the target proposition in several of the close worlds because S is distracted or preoccupied. For instance, in world W S comes to believe that a car is approaching when S sees a car coming down the road. There may very well be a close world in which S is standing in exactly that same position at that very time but does not form the belief that a car is approaching because S turns her head in the opposite direction to look at a squirrel in a tree. The lack of belief about the approaching car in these close worlds does not prevent S from safely believing in W that a car is approaching. In light of such considerations, it is useful to consider close worlds as divided into two broad categories—relevant and irrelevant—a distinction which will prove important in the discussion on skepticism. below.

Secondly, as Williamson points out (2000: 100), the safety condition is notoriously vague owing to knowledge and reliability being vague concepts. As such it is unlikely that we will arrive at a very determinate answer as to exactly which worlds count as close; our expectations must be lowered. The problems this vagueness generates will become evident in section 4.

Thirdly, as Hawthorne (2004: 56) notes, closeness, as it pertains to safety, cannot be cashed out in terms of the notion of similarity found in counterfactuals. A counterfactual of the form P ☐→ Q is non-vacuously true at a world W only if some world in which P and Q are true is closer to W than any world in which P is true but Q false. When determining the truth conditions for counterfactuals, the history of both the actual world and the close world in which the antecedent is true are held fixed. When it comes to safety, possible worlds with a different history to W can nevertheless count as close, as will become evident below. Additionally, unlike the similarity of two worlds for epistemic purposes, the similarity of worlds for the purposes of counterfactuals need not be agent-relative.

Lastly, it is unclear whether believing a truthvalueless proposition (for example, one that fails to refer) in a close world should count as a knowledge-denying error possibility. Hawthorne (2004: 56) thinks it should since these count as “failed attempts at a true belief.” None of the safety theorists discuss this type of case.

Now on to the four main determinants of closeness:

i. The Time Factor

As far as safety goes, two worlds W and W* may count as similar at a time T with respect to the set {S, P, M} yet count as distant from each another, with respect to that same set, at a time prior to or following T. Consequently, if S falsely believes P in W* at T, then S’s belief P in W at T is unsafe. The following two cases illustrate that for the purposes of safe belief closeness must be understood as indexed to a point in time.

Cases concerning knowledge of the future demonstrate that similarity between two worlds at the time of belief formation trumps dissimilarity at a later time. Suppose, for the sake of illustration, that in a world W at time T (sometime in May 2009) an agent S truly believes that London will host the 2012 Olympics as a result of reading so in a local newspaper. In many possible worlds S similarly believes as much from reading the paper.  Yet in some of these worlds things in 2012 may be radically different from the way things will be in W in 2012 when the Olympics indeed take place in London. For example, in one of these worlds W* the British economy collapses and no Olympics take place in London in 2012. In W* S’s belief at T is thus false. Nonetheless, W and W* may count as close at T despite these significant differences between these two worlds in 2012 given how similar these two worlds are with respect to the set {S, M, P, T} i.e. the details of S’s belief episode at T in which she comes to believe that London will host the 2012 Olympics as a result of reading so in the newspaper.

It is not the case, however, that for a world W* to be close to world W at T it must share a complete history with W up to and including time T. The following case elucidates this point. It is taken for granted that if in W Sally walks into a showroom displaying red shoes under red overhead lights she does not know that there are red shoes on display if there is a close world W* in which there are white shoes on display but which look red under red lights. Notice that W* counts as close to W at T even though they do not share an identical history: at T-N, where N is some duration, the factory owner in W* is placing white shoes on the display shelves and turning red lights on.

Additionally, insisting on shared histories would make safety trivially true in some cases where the target proposition believed is true and concerns the present or the past; namely, were close worlds only those worlds which share complete histories with the actual world until the moment at which the belief is formed, then it would follow that in some cases the proposition believed would be trivially safe, which is an unacceptable consequence. Accordingly, if I recall going to the gym yesterday then I know I went to the gym yesterday only if there is no close world which differs from the actual world with respect to my going to the gym yesterday and in which I falsely believe I went to the gym yesterday.

There is room to think that the conceptual content of “could easily have falsely believed” permits playing around with the time of the belief formation itself. It stands to reason, then, cases of belief formation in a possible world W* which occur shortly before or after the belief formation in W should be factored into knowledge determinations as well. If S forms a false belief in those cases then S’s belief in W is unsafe. The motivation for permitting this flexibility with the time factor is that it allows safety to handle a wide variety of cases in which time is part of the content of the proposition believed, as exemplified by the Russell case. For example, S looks at two people kissing at a new year’s party and forms the true belief that it’s the new year. S does not count as knowing that it’s the new year if there is a close world in which just prior to midnight these two people begin kissing slightly before midnight, as a result of which S falsely believes it’s the new year.

ii. What Type of Reliability does Safety Require?

Reliability, as a property of a belief-forming method, comes in different kinds, two of which are important for the purpose at hand—local and global. The latter refers to a method M’s reliability in producing a range of token output beliefs in different propositions P, Q, R, …, and so forth. A method M is globally reliable if and only if it produces sufficiently more true beliefs than false beliefs in a range of different propositions. For example, M could be the visual process and P the proposition that there is a pencil on the desk, Q the proposition that there are clouds in the sky, and R the proposition that the bin is black. If a sufficiently high number of P, Q, R, … are true then method M is globally reliable. A method M is locally reliable with respect to an individual target belief P if and only if M produces a sufficient ratio of more true beliefs than false beliefs in that very proposition P.

Accounts of knowledge in the post-Gettier period differ with regards to which type of reliability is necessary for knowledge. Nozick and Dretske think only local reliability is needed, McGinn (1999) requires global reliability to the exclusion of local reliability, and Goldman (1986: 47) requires both. Where do Williamson, Pritchard, and Sosa fall on this spectrum? With respect to (SF**), it is evident from the manner in which Sosa formulates his safety condition that he thinks that only local reliability is necessary for knowledge in so far as (SF**) concerns truly believing a specific proposition P; that is, no mention is made of not falsely believing a different proposition Q. Notice, however, that as far as safety goes, Sosa requires that the agent exhibit perfect local reliability; that is, there can be no close world in which S falsely believes P.

Unlike Sosa, Pritchard, in order to handle knowledge of necessarily true propositions, requires global reliability, but a nuanced version thereof. Recall that Pritchard permits some false beliefs in non-near close worlds but has a zero tolerance for false beliefs in the nearer close worlds. Therefore, Pritchard can be classified as requiring perfect global reliability in the near close worlds and regular global reliability in the non-near close worlds. Additionally, both Pritchard and Sosa permit falsely believing P in a close world via a different method than the one used in the actual world.

With regards to Williamson, it is much harder to pin down the type of reliability at work in (SF). As mentioned, Williamson formulates the safety condition in different ways in different places. Some of these formulations clearly advocate for local reliability only, while others incorporate global reliability. And, further still, others push for subtler versions of both. Starting with local reliability, consider this formulation:

(SF1)     “[I]n a case α one is safe from error in believing that [a condition] C obtains if and only if there is no case close to α in which one falsely believes that C obtains” (2000: 126-7).

A condition, for Williamson (ibid.: 52), is specified by a “that” clause relative to an agent and a time. Thus, “S believes that the tree is i inches tall” counts as S believing that a certain condition obtains. According to Williamson (ibid.: 114ff), a typical agent who looks at a tree and believes “that the tree is i inches tall” does not know “that the tree is i inches tall” because there is a close world in which the agent uses that same method and comes to falsely believe “that the tree is i inches tall” when in fact it is i+1 inches tall. Most people are unreliable about the height of trees to the nearest inch because our eyesight is not that powerful; we cannot tell the height of a tree to the nearest inch just by looking at it. This case demonstrates that Williamson requires local reliability since this is a case in which the agent lacks knowledge because there is a close world in which he falsely believes the same proposition using the same method as that used in the actual world. Given that for Williamson safe belief entails a zero tolerance for false belief in a close world, Williamson requires perfect local reliability.

Here is another formulation of the safety condition by Williamson (2000: 124):

(SF2)     “One avoids false belief reliably in α if and only if one avoids false belief in every  case similar enough to α.”

This formulation seems to rule out knowledge in the following case. Pat is pulling cards out of a hat on which sentences are written. Pat pulls the first out and upon reading it truly believes that oranges are fruits. Pat then pulls a second card out and upon reading the sentence written on it falsely believes that America is a province of Australia. Pat’s true belief that oranges are fruits is unsafe because Pat does not avoid false belief in a similar case; that is, Pat could easily have falsely believed a different proposition using the same method in a close world. Because Pat uses a globally unreliable method she lacks knowledge. Given that for Williamson, safe belief entails a zero tolerance for false belief in a close world, Williamson therefore also requires perfect global reliability.

Yet further formulations of safety by Williamson advocate for subtler versions of local and global reliability. Recall that as Pritchard and Sosa present the safety condition, knowing P is compatible with falsely believing P via a different method in a close world. Williamson agrees, but with a caveat:

(SF3)    “P is required to be true only in similar cases in which it is believed on a similar basis” (2009: 364-5).

So for S to safely believe P via M not only must S not falsely believe P in any close world via M, S must also not falsely believe P using a relevantly similar method to M. Williamson extends this principle in a way that results in a non-standard version of global reliability:

(SF4)   If in a case α one knows P on a basis B, then in any case close to α in which one believes a proposition P* close to P on a basis [B*] close to B, then P* is true (2009: 325).

In other words, to safely believe P via M in α it must also be the case that one does not falsely believe P* via M* in a close case. For ease of reference, here is a gloss in the vicinity of Williamson’s conception of a safe belief:

(SF!)  S safely believes P via a method M in world W if and only if there is no close world to W in which:

(i)    S falsely believes P via M or a relevantly similar method M*; or

(ii)   S falsely believes any proposition via M; or

(iii)  S falsely believes a relevantly similar proposition P* using a relevantly similar method M*.

Williamson is thus committed to S knowing P in W at T only if S (SF!)-safely believes P. Since Williamson’s picture of “could easily have falsely believed” is richer than Pritchard’s or Sosa’s, more is needed to be safe from error for Williamson than for the latter two.

There are reasons independent of any of these three authors that suggest that knowledge should require both global and a local reliability. Firstly, the problem of vagueness supports a global reliability formulation of safety as follows. Some vague concepts may have different meanings in different worlds. It follows, then, that sentences with the same words can express different propositions in different worlds even when these worlds are very close (Williamson 1994: 230-4). For example, the property expressed by bald in the actual world might be having less than twenty hairs on one’s head while the property expressed by bald in a close world W might be having less than eighteen hairs on one’s head. If this is the case, then the sentence Pollock is bald expresses different propositions in these two worlds. Hence if Jackson, in the actual world, believes of Pollock that he is bald (Pollock having nineteen hairs on his head) then his belief will turn out to be unsafe as there is a close world, namely W, in which Jackson falsely believes of Pollock that he is bald. In cases such as these, for an agent to know P via M it must be the case that the agent could not easily have falsely believed P* via M (where P* counts as a different proposition in that close world).

Knowledge of propositions with singular content requires safety to be formulated in a globally reliable way. Consider the case in which Jones, looking at a real barn surrounded by fake barns, forms the true belief that “that is a barn.” The intuition is to deny Jones knowledge despite the fact that there is no close world in which that very barn is not a barn (assuming that a barn is essentially a barn). Since Jones could easily have falsely believed of a fake barn that “that is a barn,” which expresses a different and false proposition, Jones is denied knowledge.

iii. Methods

Methods can be individuated in a variety of ways: internally or externally, and in a coarse-grained or fine-grained way.

A way of individuating methods is internal if it respects the constraint that agents who form a belief P and who are internal duplicates share the same method; and external if it does not respect that constraint. Alternatively, if method individuation supervenes solely on brain states, then methods are internally individuated; if two agents can be in the same brain state yet be using different methods, then methods are individuated externally.

A way of individuating methods is coarse-grained if methods are described broadly or generally for example, the visual method. On the other hand, a way of individuating methods is fine-grained if methods are described in detail for example, the visual method for large objects at close range under favorable lighting conditions. As the degree of detail to which a method can be described is a parameter along a continuous spectrum, fine-grained and coarse-grained individuation permit of a wide range of generality or detail. Specifying the relevant detail for each method is known as the generality problem for reliabilism. Given that reliably believing is part of safety, safety faces the generality problem, something Williamson acknowledges (2009: 308).

Nozick (1981: 233) argues for an accessibility constraint on method individuation; that is, regardless of how methods are individuated, a difference in methods must always be accessible to the agent. It is evident, then, that an accessibility constraint is in tension with both external and fine-grained individuation since, ex hypothesi, neither the difference between seeing and hallucinating nor the difference between two finely-grained methods would be detectable by the typical agent.

Williamson and Pritchard deny such an accessibility constraint, thereby opening the way for external, fine-grained individuation of methods. For Williamson the accessibility constraint assumes that methods are a luminous condition, where a luminous condition is defined as a condition such that whenever it obtains the agent is in a position to know that it obtains (Williamson 2000: 95). But, as Williamson (ibid.: 96-8) argues, no non-trivial condition is luminous. Therefore the accessibility condition should be disregarded.

Pritchard (2005: 153) argues that safety will get the wrong result in some cases unless the accessibility condition is dropped because agents are fallible when it comes to determining which methods they use. For example, S might incorrectly think that she believes P via method M when in fact she believes it via M*. In some cases M delivers safe belief while M* doesn’t. Were the relevant method for a determination of safety the method the agent considers to be the one by which she believes, safety would get the wrong result in such cases.

One further argument against the accessibility condition is that it generates an infinite regress: S must be aware of which method she uses to believe P, the method she used to determine that, the method she used to determine that, and so on. Although these three arguments do not entail that internal and coarse-grained individuation are unsustainable, they do show that one reason in favor of such positions is unpromising.

We typically talk about methods or bases of belief in a coarse-grained way.  Williamson, however, adopts a fine-grained, external individuation of bases. For example, Williamson (2009b: 307, 325 n.13) thinks that, other things being equal, seeing a daschund and seeing a wolf count as different bases; believing that one is drinking pure, unadulterated water on the basis of drinking pure, unadulterated water from a glass is not the same basis as believing as much when drinking water from a glass that has been doctored with undetectable toxins by conniving agents; believing that one was shown x number of flashes after drinking regular orange juice does not count as the same basis as believing that one was shown x number of flashes after drinking a glass of orange juice with a tasteless mind-altering drug; and, finally, believing that S₁ is married by looking at S₁’s wedding ring and believing that S₂ is married by looking at S₂’s wedding ring count as different methods if S₁ reliably wears her ring and S₂ does not.

Williamson is inclined towards external, (super) fine-grained individuation of methods owing to his position vis-à-vis luminosity and skepticism. Regarding the former, in some cases the circumstances of a case can change in very gradual ways that the agent fails to detect such that at the start of the case the basis of belief is reliable while unreliable at the end of the case. Consider, for example, a case in which I see a pencil on a desk in front of me under favorable conditions. Assumedly I know that there is a pencil on the desk. I then begin to gradually walk backwards from the desk all the while keeping my eyes on the pencil until I reach a point at which it appears as a mere blur in the distance. At that point beliefs I form based on vision are no more than guesses. At each point in my growing distance from the desk my visual abilities start deteriorating slowly such that at some indiscernible point my eyesight no longer counts as reliable with respect to the pencil. Were bases of belief individuated in an internal, coarse-grained manner such that my looking at the pencil close-up and my looking at the pencil at a distance count as the same method, then I would fail to know that there is a pencil on the desk when close to the table since there is a close world in which I look at it from a distance and form a false belief that there is pen on the desk, which is intuitively the incorrect result. Consequently, minimal changes in the external environment result in a difference in the basis of belief formation.

iv. Skepticism

One of the selling points of safety is that it, unlike the relevant alternatives and sensitivity conditions, permits one to know the denial of skeptical hypotheses, thereby maintaining closure. Here is the skeptical argument from closure:

(1)   I know I have hands.

(2)   If I know I have hands then I know I am not a brain in the vat.

(3)   I don’t know that I am not a brain in the vat.

This triad is inconsistent because, claims the skeptic, one cannot know the denials of skeptical hypotheses; that is, one cannot know that one is not in the bad case (the denial of (3)). In other words, if I know I have hands, then by closure I should know I am not a handless brain in the vat. But, claims the skeptic, one is never in a position to know that one is not a handless brain in the vat. It follows, then, that I do not know that I have hands.

Pritchard (2005: 159) claims that if one is in the good case then one sees that one has hands based on perception. In the bad case one does not see that one has hands; rather, one is fed images of hands. As a result of this difference in method, the bad case automatically counts as irrelevant since only those cases in which one forms beliefs based on veridical perception count as relevant: “only those nearby possible worlds in which the agent formed her belief in the same way as in the actual world are at issue” (ibid. 161). Since, by definition of the cases, the brain in the vat is not using the same method as the agent in the good case, one can consequently know the denial of the skeptical hypothesis entailed by one’s knowledge of everyday propositions since there is no close world to the good case in which one falsely believes the denial of the skeptical hypothesis.

Williamson resists skepticism by exposing and undermining those claims that tempt us towards (3); namely the idea that a brain in the vat and the agent in the good case have exactly the same evidence. According to Williamson (2000: 9) “one’s total evidence is simply one’s total knowledge.” Since the agent in the good case has good evidence and the brain the vat has bad evidence, this constitutes a sufficient dissimilarity between the cases. Therefore, the false belief in the bad case counts as irrelevant to true belief in the good case. Alternatively, Williamson can be read as saying that individuating methods externally and in a fine-grained manner leads to the conclusion that believing truly on the basis of good evidence is sufficiently dissimilar to believing falsely on the basis of bad evidence (ibid.: 169). The epistemic impoverishment of the brain in the vat is thus irrelevant. Williamson (2009d: 21) has made the following further claim:

The idea is that when one knows p “on basis b,” worlds in which one does not believe p “on basis b” do not count as close; but knowing “on basis b” requires p to be true in all close worlds in which one believes p “on basis b;” thus p is true in all close worlds. In this sense, the danger from which one is safe is p’s being false, not only one’s believing p when it is false.

Thus the bad case counts as far off because in the bad case P is false. This difference between the good and bad cases constitutes a sufficient dissimilarity to permit one to know in the good case.

Since Sosa is not as explicit about how he builds methods into his safety condition, all three strategies are compatible with what he says. For example, he sometimes talks as if the bad case is far off (1999a: 147; 2000: 15), while at other times (1999b: 379) he can be read as thinking that even if it were close it would be irrelevant because the agent is using a different method in that case.

There are thus three different strategies a safety theorist can employ to oppose skepticism:

(i)  Since the agent in the bad case uses a different method from the agent in the good case, the bad case is sufficiently dissimilar from the good case and thus does not count as close;

(ii) The bad case counts as close to the good case yet is irrelevant given that the agent in the bad case uses a different method from the agent in the good case;

(iii) While the agents in the good and bad cases use the same method, the bad case counts as far off given the overall dissimilarities between it and the good case;

The safety condition is therefore a powerful tool against skepticism. For skepticism to be an appealing theory the skeptic would have to provide some reason for thinking that in  every case α involving an agent S, method M, time T, and proposition P, there is a close  and relevant case β in which a skeptical hypothesis is true such that S could easily have failed to be locally or globally reliable in α with respect to P at T (where the definitions of local and global reliability differ depending on which safety theorist is in question).

b. How do the Safety and Sensitivity Conditions Differ?

Given that the sensitivity condition for knowledge enjoyed such prominence, it is important to determine how the safety condition differs from it. Such a comparison will shed light on some virtues of the safety condition relative to the sensitivity condition.

In some cases sensitivity is the more stringent condition, while in others safety is. The following two points of logic elicit the difference between the safety and sensitivity conditions. When it comes to cases concerning knowledge of the denial of skeptical hypotheses, the safety principle is less demanding than the sensitivity principle. The latter principle requires that the agent not believe P in the nearest possible world in which P is false. As such no agent can know the denial of skeptical hypotheses by the simple sensitivity test, for example, I am not a brain in the vat, because in the nearest possible world in which the agent is a brain in the vat the agent continues to believe (falsely) that he is not a brain in the vat. So while agents typically satisfy the sensitivity condition with respect to everyday propositions and thus count as knowing many everyday propositions, they cannot satisfy the sensitivity condition with respect to the denial of skeptical hypothesis. Hence the incompatibility of the sensitivity condition and single-premise closure, for knowledge of everyday propositions entails knowledge of the denial of skeptical hypotheses incompatible with those propositions.

The safety principle, however, is compatible with single-premise closure for it permits knowing the denial of skeptical hypotheses. By the safety principle I count as knowing the everyday proposition P “that I have hands” by method M only if I safely believe P. It follows, then, that if I safely believe P then there is no close world in which I am a brain in the vat and am led to falsely believe that I have hands by M (as explained in the previous section). Consequently, if I know that I have hands and I know that that entails that I am not a brain in the vat, then I know that I am not a brain in the vat.

On the other hand, cases can be constructed in which safety is more demanding than sensitivity. Consider the following case: S truly believes P via M in the actual world but (i) in the closest world in which P is false S does not believe P, and (ii) there is a close world in which S falsely believes P via M. In this case S satisfies the sensitivity condition but fails to satisfy the safety condition. A case by Goldman (1986: 45) can be used to illustrate this point. Mary has an unreliable thermometer in her medicine cabinet which she uses to measure her temperature. It just so happens to correctly read her temperature of 38°C in this case. However, in the nearest world in which her temperature is not 38°C and she uses this thermometer to take her temperature, she is distracted by her son and she doesn’t form any belief about her temperature. She accordingly satisfies the sensitivity condition for knowledge since she does not believe P in the nearest world in which P is false. However, there is some other close world in which she uses this thermometer to take her temperature and forms a false belief thereby. Mary thus fails to satisfy the safety condition. It follows, then, that the following pair of conditionals are false:

If S safely believes P then S sensitively believes P.

If S sensitively believes P then S safely believes P.

The logic of these conditionals makes explicit the respects in which safety is similar to and different from the sensitivity condition.

c. The Semantics of Safety

In a non-epistemic context it is easy to see that “safe” can function as a gradable adjective. For instance, if S has three paths to choose from to get to her destination, it is perfectly acceptable to say that although path X is safe, Y is safer, and that path Z the safest of the three paths. “Similarity” also comes in degrees: London is more similar to Manchester than to Kabul. Possible worlds can thus be closer to or further from the actual world on a sliding scale of similarity. S’s belief P, therefore, can be safer than S’s belief Q. Although “safe” is a gradable adjective, the safety condition is not presented within the framework of a contextualist semantics for “knowledge,” where, roughly speaking, contextualism about ”knowledge” is the claim that the truth conditions of the proposition “S knows P” depend on the context of the attributer. In other words, “knowledge” picks out different relations in the different contexts of attribution where said contexts are a function of the varying interests of the attributer, not the possessor, of knowledge. Contextualism has gained its popularity through, among other things, its proposed solution to the skeptical challenge from closure. Sosa, Williamson, and Pritchard are all standard invariantists about the semantics of knowledge, invariantism being the denial of contextualism. (See Williamson (2009d: 18) for two different ways in which the gradability of safety can be accommodated without adopting a contextualist semantics for “know.”) If one’s main concern is skepticism, then the safety theorist has no need for a contextualist semantics for “knowledge” given the three strategies available to them for opposing skepticism (listed above). Nonetheless, it is easy enough to see how one could model the safety condition along contextualist lines if one had independent reasons for adopting a contextualist semantics for “knowledge”—those factors that weigh in on the similarity measure of close worlds will be those salient to the attributer, not the agent.

4. Safety in Action

To get a better feel for how the safety condition works, it proves beneficial to undertake an exercise in seeing how safety handles some of the troubling cases in the literature. Obviously each case can be modified in such a way as to make things harder or easier for the safety theorist. For present purposes such cases will be ignored.

a. Gettier and Chisholm

Jones is told by his boss that Smith will get the promotion. Jones then sees Smith putting ten  coins in his pocket. Jones accordingly infers that the man who will get the promotion has ten coins in his pocket. However, Jones (not Smith) gets the job and Jones just so happens to have ten coins in his pocket. According to Gettier (1963) Jones’s belief does not amount to knowledge. How does the safety condition handle this case? Jones’s belief is unsafe because there are close worlds in which (a) in which Carter gets the job but has no coins in his pocket, or (b) in which Jones get the job but has nine coins in his pocket.

The same reasoning applies to Chisholm’s (1977) case in which Jones believes that there is a sheep in the field upon seeing a fluffy white animal in the distance. However, while what Jones sees is a white dog there is indeed a sheep in the field lying behind a rock hidden from Jones’s sight. According to Chisholm, Jones doesn’t count as knowing that there is a sheep in the field. The safety condition captures this intuition. Jones’s belief is unsafe because there is a close world in which there is no sheep behind the rock and Jones falsely believes that there is a sheep in the field; that is, the method of inferring the presence of sheep by seeing dogs is unreliable.

b. Fake Barns

Jones is in an area with many fake barns. Jones sees a real barn in the field and forms the belief that there is a barn in the field. Does Jones know that there is a barn in the field? Prima facie, Jones’s belief counts as unsafe as there is a close world in which he looks at a fake barn and falsely believes that it is a (real) barn.

However, this case turns out to be a little harder to explain because the details of the case can be manipulated into yielding bizarre intuitions in similarly structured cases (Hawthorne and Gendler 2005). What if, for example, Jones would not have come across such a fake barn because he wasn’t in walking distance of it? The permutations of the standard setup of this case abound (see for example, Peacocke (1999: 324), Neta and Rohrbaugh (2004: 399), Comesaña (2005: 396), and Lackey (2006)). Similar permutations can be made for the Gettier and Chisholm cases, for example, where circumstances are such that the person who gets the job in all close worlds has ten coins in his or her pocket or that in all close worlds there is a sheep behind the rock.

This is one of those cases that manifests the vagueness present in the safety condition. As Williamson (2000: 100; 2009b: 305) indicates, there will be cases in which whether or not one thinks that there is a close world in which the agent falsely believes depends on whether or not one is inclined to attribute knowledge to that agent in that case; the vagueness in “relevantly similar,” “reliable,” and “knowledge” knowledge determinations in some cases notoriously difficult. Accordingly, the direction of one’s intuitions about whether or not Jones knows in each permutation of these cases will influence whether or not one thinks Jones has a false belief in a close world, and vice versa.

There is one significant permutation of this case that requires attention. Suppose the details of the case remain identical except that instead of forming the belief P that there is a barn in the field, Jones forms the belief Q that that is a barn (Hawthorne 2004: 56). Recall that Q is a singular proposition but P is not, where, roughly, a singular proposition is one that is constitutively about some particular. Sosa would have to find other reasons to deny Jones knowledge in this case, if he thinks he lacks it, given that his safety condition requires local reliability and true singular propositions are true in all close worlds. According to Williamson and Pritchard, Jones lacks knowledge in this case because there is a close world in which Jones looks at a fake barn and his belief that that is a barn expresses a different and false proposition.

c. Matches

Jones is about to light a match and forms the belief that the match will light once struck since all dry matches of this brand that he has struck have lit after being struck. However, the match doesn’t light because it was struck but rather does so because of some rare burst of radiation (adapted from Skyrms 1967: 383). Stipulate further that in all close worlds the match lights by friction. Is Jones’s belief safe?

The safety theorist seems drawn into denying knowledge in this case because there is a sense in which Jones is still lucky, in an epistemically malignant way, that his belief is true. When described in this way, this case is a stronger version of many of the Gettier cases mentioned so far because Jones’s belief is true by luck in the actual world but not so in any close world. Such cases would demonstrate that safety is not necessary for knowledge.

One way around this difficulty would be via Williamson’s claim that worlds which differ as far as trends go count as far off (see below B(i)). Hence, only worlds in which the match lights by a freak burst of radiation count as close. If worlds are ordered in this way, the example is presented in a flawed way that incorrectly indicates a problem for safety. Since the match lights in all those close worlds via radiation, Jones knows that his match will light.

5. Problems for Safety

As epistemologists ponder the details of the safety condition, it is to be expected that some will identify what they perceive to be its weaknesses or its failures. This section is devoted to three problem areas for safety.

a. Knowledge of Necessarily True Propositions

A necessarily true proposition is one which is true in all possible worlds. One might think, therefore, that knowledge of such propositions presents a problem for safety since there can be no close world in which S falsely believes such propositions. It should be clear at this point that this is a problem primarily for Sosa since his condition requires local reliability only; that is, not falsely believing P in close worlds. In other words, the counterfactual B(P) ☐→ P will be trivially true for any proposition P which is necessarily true. So knowledge of necessarily true propositions is going to be a problem for any account of knowledge that requires local reliability only.

Williamson and Pritchard have no such problems with knowledge of necessary truths since both require global reliability. There are cases that demonstrate that the method used to believe a necessarily true proposition can be globally unreliable. For example, suppose I use a coin to decide whether to believe 42 x 17 = 714 or to believe 32 ÷ 0.67 = 40, where I have no idea which is true without the use of a calculator. If the coin lands in such a way indicating that I should believe the first, which is necessarily true, then I am lucky to believe the necessary truth and not the necessary falsehood. I consequently do not know that 42 x 17 = 714 as I could just have easily have falsely believed the different proposition expressed by  32 ÷ 0.67 = 40.

b. Knowledge of the Future

The following lottery puzzle is particularly troublesome for safety. On the assumption that a proposition about a future state of affairs is either true or false, we take ourselves to know many things about the future, for example, that the Lakers game is next Tuesday, or that the elections will be held next month. This being the case, intuitively at least, Suzy knows that she won’t be able to afford to buy a new house this year. On the other hand, we deny that Suzy knows that her lottery ticket will lose (even if the draw has already taken place and Suzy has not yet learnt of the draw result). This state of affairs, however, presents the following puzzle: assuming single-premise closure true, if Suzy knows that she won’t be able to afford to buy a new house this year, and knows that this entails that her ticket is a loser, then Suzy should be in a position to know that her ticket will lose (by deduction). But it is commonly held that agents do not know that their lottery tickets will lose. (The aptness of this intuition is often demonstrated by the impropriety of flatly asserting that one knows that one’s ticket will lose, or selling one’s ticket for a penny before learning of the draw results.) The intuitive pull of single-premise closure is in tension with intuitions about what can be known about the future and about lottery tickets.

Problems involving lotteries generalize (Hawthorne 2004: 3). For instance, we are willing to say that Peter knows that (P) he will be living in Sydney this coming year. Yet we are hesitant to say that Peter knows that (Q) he won’t be one of those unfortunate few to be involved in a fatal car accident in the coming months. Assuming single premise closure true, if we are willing to attribute to Peter knowledge of P, and Peter knows that P entails Q, we should then be willing to attribute Peter knowledge of Q.

One way of explaining why agents do not know that their lottery tickets will lose or that they won’t die in unexpected accidents is that both events have a non-zero objective probability of occurring. That is, events with a non-zero probability of occurring can occur in close worlds. Naturally, then, one might think that the world in which one’s lottery ticket wins or in which one dies from an unexpected motor accident is close and that therefore one’s beliefs that one will lose the lottery or not die in an accident are unsafe.

This line of thinking is devastating for safety, however, as it would effectively rule out knowledge of any propositions the content of which regards the future since, assuming indeterminism true, there is a non-zero probability that any proposition about the future will be false; that is, for any true proposition P about the future there will be a close world in which P is false and one believes P. If safety leads directly to skepticism about knowledge of the future this would be a good reason to give up safety.

One line of thought for a safety theorist to pursue in response to this problem is to support the following high-chance-close-world principle (HCCW): if there is a high objective chance at T₁ that the proposition P believed by S at T₁ will be false at T₂ given the state of the world at T₁ and the laws of nature, then S does not know P at T₁ as P is unsafe (even if P is true). The thinking behind this response is that if there is a high chance of some event occurring then that event could easily have occurred, which indicates that there is a natural connection between high chance and danger. For instance, if there is a high objective chance that the tornado will move in the direction of Kentucky, then it seems natural to say that Kentucky’s inhabitants are in danger.

Hawthorne and Lasonen-Aarnio (2009) demonstrate that HCCW presents some rather unwelcomed problems for the safety theorist. Firstly, HCCW is in tension with knowledge by multi-premise closure. Suppose, by way of example, that at T₁ a subject S knows a range of chancy propositions P, Q, R, … about the future; that is, there is no close world in which any of those propositions are false. That said, while there may be a low probability for each proposition in that set that it will be false, for a sufficiently high number of propositions the probability at T₁ that the conjunction of {P, Q, R, …} will be true at T₂ will be very low . Accordingly, the probability of the negation of {P, Q, R, …} is very high at T₁. By the lights of HCCW there will then be a close world in which that conjunction is false. Therefore, while an agent may know each conjunct in a set of chancy propositions about the future, the safety theorist who is committed to HCCW must deny that the agent knows the conjunction of those propositions. HCCW is therefore incompatible with multi-premise closure.

HCCW also creates problems for single-premise closure. Consider Plumpton who is about to begin a significantly long series of deductions from a true premise P₁ towards a true conclusion P_N. Suppose that at every step there is a significantly low objective probability that Plumpton’s deductive faculty will misfire leading him towards a false belief. If the chain is sufficiently long then there will be a high enough probability that the belief at the end of Plumpton’s deductive chain will be false, in which case, by HCCW, such a possibility counts as close. If closeness of worlds is cashed out in terms of HCCW, then Plumpton does not know P_N if he deduced it from P_N-1, which is effectively the denial of single-premise closure for whenever the chance that the next step will be false is high enough (for example, the step leading from P_N-1 to P_N in Plumpton’s case) the deduction from that previous step will be ruled out as unsafe. The same problem arises for knowing a proposition at the end of a very long testimony or memory chain when there is a non-zero objective probability that the process will go astray at any given link of the chain.

Moreover, HCCW also struggles to explain the inconsistency of why, in some cases, we do attribute knowledge to agents concerning events with substantially low probabilities of occurring while in some case we do not. For instance, we are happy to say, following Greco (2007) and Vogel (1999), that a veteran cop knows that his rookie partner will fail to disarm the mugger by shooting a bullet down the barrel of the mugger’s gun, or that not all sixty golfers will score a hole-in-one on the par three hole, or that this monkey will not type out a copy of War and Peace if placed in front of a computer. Yet it is common to deny knowledge in the lottery case where the chances are substantially lower.

The safety theorist, therefore, owes us some story about how close worlds calibrate in cases involving objective chance.

i. Williamson’s Response

Williamson denies that there is a straightforward correlation between safety and objective probability. When it comes to knowledge there are two conceptions of safety that one can have—a no risk conception or a small risk conception. Williamson (2009d) rejects the latter owing to the way we use the concepts of safety and danger in ordinary, non-epistemic contexts. By way of argument, Williamson (ibid.: 11) asks us to consider the following two valid arguments that involve the use of our ordinary, non-epistemic concept “safe,” where the context is held fixed between premises and conclusion:

Argument Asafety	S was shot
	───────────────────────
	S was not safe from being shot

 

Argument Bsafety	S was safe from being shot by X
	S was safe from being shot by Y
	S was safe from being shot by Z
	S was safe from being shot other than by X, Y, or Z
	───────────────────────────
	S was safe from being shot

Williamson then asks us to consider which of the two competing conception of safety (the “small risk” or “no risk”) secures the validity of these arguments by plugging in these conceptions in the relevant premises and conclusions:

Argument Asmall risk	S was shot
	─────────────────────────
	S’s risk of being shot was not small

Argument Bsmall risk	S’s risk of being shot by X was small
	S’s risk of being shot by Y was small
	S’s risk of being shot by Z was small
	S’s risk of being shot other than by X, Y, or Z was small
	───────────────────────────────────────
	S’s risk of being shot was small

 

Argument Ano risk	S was shot
	───────────────────────────
	S was at some risk of being shot

 

Argument Bno risk	S was at no risk of being shot by X
	S was at no risk of being shot by Y
	S was at no risk of being shot by Z
	S was at no risk of being shot by other than X, Y, or Z
	──────────────────────────────────────
	S was at no risk of being shot

With regards to the “small risk” conception of safety, the argument A _{small risk} is invalid since even events with a small risk of occurring in a world W do occur in W, for example, lottery wins. Argument B _{small risk} is invalid because small risks add up to large ones. On the other hand, the “no risk” conception of safety fairs much better for these reasons. Since S was shot in some world close to W, and W being the closest world to itself, S was at some risk of being shot, which demonstrates the validity of Argument A _{no risk}. This explains why S is not safe from being shot in W at a time T. Similarly, Argument B _{no risk} is valid since if S was not shot by X in any close world to W at T, and so on with respect to Y, or Z or anyone else, then there is no close world in which S was shot. This exercise with the ordinary conception of safety demonstrates that the ordinary conception thereof is not in terms of small risk or probability. (Peacocke (1999: 310-11) likewise understands the concept of safety in this way: “The relevant kind of possibility is one under which something’s not being possible means that in a certain way one can rely on its not obtaining” (original emphasis).) Therefore, argues Williamson, the notion of a safe belief is not one correlated with probability.

In light of this divergence between safety and probability, one counts as safely believing a conjunction, by Williamson’s lights,  if and only if one safely believes the conjunction on a basis that includes safely believing each conjunct. Similarly, if one safely believes P and safely believes P → Q, then one safely believes Q if and only if the basis on which one believes Q includes the basis on which one believes P and P → Q, for in that case there will be no close world in which one believes Q and Q is false. It stands to reason then, that there will be cases in which S safely believes P and safely believes P → Q, yet does not safely believe Q since the basis on which S believes the latter does not include the basis of the former two beliefs. One must safely derive that which is entailed by what one already safely believes before one counts as safely believing the entailment: “We might say that safe derivation means that one makes a ‘knowledgeable’ connection from premises to conclusion, rather than that one knows the connection” (Williamson 2009d: 27).

Given these arguments, Williamson (ibid.: 19), demonstrates that in some cases knowing and objective probability dramatically diverge. For example, suppose I designate the winning lottery ticket “Lucky” and then believe that Lucky will win the lottery (where “Lucky” is a rigid designator). Nonetheless, I count as knowing in advance that Lucky will win despite each ticket having the very same low probability of winning.

For these reasons the cases involving knowledge of risky propositions do not bother a no risk conception of safety so long as one safely believes the conjunction on a basis that includes the bases on which one safely believes each conjunct. The same applies to very lengthy derivations. It stands to reason, then, that Plumpton knows P_N despite there being a very high objective probability that P_N is false. And so long as there is no close world in which one falsely believes a proposition P about the future, then one safely believes P despite there being a non-zero-probability that P is false, for example, that no monkey will type out War and Peace, that not all sixty golfers will score a hole-in-one, or that the rookie will not disarm the mugger. With respect to knowledge of the future, Williamson (2009c: 327) writes that “the occurrence of an event in β that bucks a relevant trend in α may be a relevant lack of closeness between α and β, even though the trend falls well short of a being a strict law.” Trends are further indicators of closeness between cases. So in a case α an agent S can be in a position to know a proposition P about the future even though there is a non-zero probability that P will be false since the case β in which it is false is sufficiently distant from α owing to P’s being false in β bucking a trend in α.

Matters involving lottery puzzles remain troublesome for Williamson, however. In the cases where the known proposition entails a risky proposition about the future for example, that one will be healthy for the rest of the year, Williamson is happy to admit that one does safely believe that risky proposition given the divergence between safety and small risk (as explained above). However, this seems to indicate that Williamson is happy to permit that one can safely infer that one’s lottery ticket will lose, which is problematic since it contradicts a widely-held intuition and goes against Williamson’s prior commitment in print that one does not know that one’s ticket will lose (2000: 117, 247). In conversation Williamson has made two salient remarks in response to these points. First, he still maintains that one does not know one’s ticket will lose when this belief is formed on the basis of reflecting on the low odds of it winning. He is open to one’s knowing that one’s ticket will lose by other bases of belief, for example, safe derivation from known propositions about the future. So in some lottery puzzles Williamson will concede that one can know that one’s ticket will lose. Second, Williamson has emphasized that lottery puzzles are unstable since one readily attributes knowledge about the future only to retract it when the lottery entailment becomes salient. Since Williamson’s concerns are the structural features of knowledge, he is not overly perturbed by problems generated by specific cases which rest on very unstable intuitions.

ii. Pritchard’s Response

Pritchard (2008: 41; 2009: 29), like Williamson, argues that the relationship between objective probability and safety is not one of direct correlation but motivates his claim using intuitions from a different lottery case. We say that S does not know by reflecting on the extremely long odds of winning a lottery that her ticket will lose (even if the draw has already occurred and S is unaware of the results) but that S does know that it lost from reading the result in the newspaper. This is a somewhat surprising result given that the objective probability of being wrong in the former case is lower than in the latter case since newspapers do sometimes print errors. Were closeness determined according to the HCCW principle, the the intuitions should be the converse. Safety, argues Pritchard, captures the intuitions in this case since the world in which one wins a lottery is very much like the actual world since all that differentiates the two worlds in this context is a bunch of balls falling differently. That is why one cannot know that one’s ticket will lose. However, given the copious editing processes at newspapers, quite a bit would have to go wrong for there to be a printing error.

Using this understanding of closeness Pritchard believes he can answer the lottery puzzles Hawthorne raises. Pritchard contends that we are mistaken in thinking that these are puzzles because our intuitions are being misled by a lack of detail in the presentation of the cases (ibid. 43-8). If S has a lottery ticket in his pocket for a draw taking place tomorrow, Pritchard claims that we ought to resist attributing knowledge to S that he won’t have enough money to go on a safari this year since the world in which he wins a major prize in the forthcoming lottery is close. In such a case, argues Pritchard, the agent also does not know that his ticket will lose. Conversely, if S does not have a lottery ticket in hand, then S knows he won’t go on safari and knows that he won’t win the lottery. Either way closure is preserved.

In a similar fashion Pritchard argues away some of the other lottery-like puzzles. If we are told that S is a healthy person then we are prone to affirm that S knows that S will be living in Wyoming this coming year and that S knows that S won’t have a heart attack since the world in which S, a healthy person drops dead from a totally unexpected heart attack, is far off. Likewise, if we are told that S has very high cholesterol, then we will deny that S knows that S will be living in Wyoming this year and that S won’t have a heart attack. Closure is maintained in both cases.

Some might have reservations about the adequacy of Pritchard’s response, however. It is a matter of differing intuitions whether or not there is a relevant difference between the actual world and worlds in which perfectly healthy people die from a sudden and unexpected heart attack or are involved in a fatal car accident. If such worlds are relevantly similar to the actual world, then such worlds should accordingly count as close on Pritchard’s line of thought. Therefore, contrary to Pritchard, such agents should be denied knowledge of their future whereabouts. The same line of reasoning can be applied to the lottery and newspaper case; the world in which the type setting machine prints an error owing to a technical glitch is much closer to the actual world than the world in which the seven balls corresponding to the numbers on one’s lottery ticket fall into the dedicated slots because much less has to change in the former case than in the latter case. If closeness of worlds is determined by how much the two worlds actually differ on the details of the case, then one ought to be unable to know stuff by reading the newspaper, which is an untenable result. Finally, it is also unclear how Pritchard’ strategy can handle the troublesome cases involving multi-premise closure that Hawthorne and Lasonen-Aarnio describe. The world in which Plumpton makes a mistake in the very long deductive chain he is about to embark upon seems very similar to the actual world. A natural reading of “at each step the chance that he will make a mistake is exceedingly low but that he will make a mistake overall exceedingly high” is that the two worlds are very similar; not much change is required for Plumpton to make a mistake somewhere along the way.

Despite these concerns, the disparity between closeness and objective probability that Pritchard is urging does seem to handle the Vogel and Greco cases quite well. Events in the actual would have to change significantly for sixty golfers all to score holes-in-one, or for the rookie to disarm the mugger, or for the monkey to type War and Peace.  The angles of the club face, timing, ball spin, wind speeds, strength of swing, and so forth. would all have to somehow fall together in such a way on sixty different occasions for all sixty golfers to succeed in scoring holes-in-one. Similar thoughts apply to the rookie and monkey cases.

c. Safety and Determinism

The safety theorist argues that if S knows P then S could not have easily been wrong. Suppose, for the sake of argument, that our world is a deterministic world  in the sense that the state of the world at T_N is determined by the state of the world at T_N—1 plus the laws of nature.. In what sense, then, could S have easily gone wrong since, if determinism is true, S could not but have believed P truly? Williamson (2000: 124, 2009: 325) argues that “determinism does not trivialize safety.” Williamson demonstrates this point by way of an example of a ball balanced on the tip of a cone. Such a ball, even in a deterministic world, is not safe from falling because, argues Williamson, the initial conditions could easily have been different such that the ball falls. By the “initial conditions” he means “the time of the case, not to the beginning of the universe” (2000: 124).

The suggestion, then, seems to be that in a case α in a deterministic world W, S safely believes P if and only if had the initial conditions of the case been slightly different S would still have truly believed P. What remains unclear, however, is why Williamson says that only the initial conditions of the case need to be changed and not the initial conditions of the universe, for, after all, altering the initial conditions of the case in a deterministic world can only be achieved if one alters the initial conditions of the universe itself. So altering the initial conditions of the case necessitates altering the initial conditions of the universe. In addition, on some conceptions of determinism, small scale changes at the beginning of the universe generate large-scale changes further down the chain of events. Consequently, it is unclear whether altering the initial conditions of the universe will generate sufficiently similar cases in which S falsely believes P. Finally, it seems somewhat odd to say that even if the actual world is a deterministic world, then even though I am currently typing in Oxford I could just have easily been hunting bears in Mongolia since a slight alteration in the initial conditions of the universe would have resulted in my being a bear hunter.

One maneuver a safety theorist can make in response to the foregoing difficulties is to adopt a move Lewis makes in his work on the semantics of counterfactuals. Suppose a world W is a deterministic world and in a case α in W S truly believes P at T. The safety theorist could argue that S safely believes P at T in W if and only if had there been a small miracle at T or some time shortly before T such that different conditions prevailed in a case β very similar to α, S truly believes P. (Williamson has raised such an option in conversation.)

Some might be wary of such a metaphysics since they would assume that miracles are not the kind of things we want in our ontology or epistemology. So it appears that unless the safety theorist wishes to adopt a somewhat unorthodox metaphysics, safety, despite Williamson’s insistence to the contrary, is hostage to determinism. But in the safety theorist’s defense, our best physics seems to provide a better case for indeterminism than determinism. It remains the case, nevertheless, that the safety theorist needs be more forthcoming about the relationship between the physical conditions of the world and the modality of the safety condition.

6. References and Further Reading

• Armstrong, D. 1973. Belief, Truth, and Knowledge. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • An important early contribution to the study of knowledge in the post-Gettier period, particularly the idea that knowledge requires reliability.
• Chisholm, R. 1977. Theory of Knowledge. 2^nd ed. NJ: Prentice Hall.
  • One of the notable works in the early period of contemporary analytic epistemology.
• Comesaña, J. 2005. “Unsafe Knowledge.” Synthese 146: 395-404.
  • This author argues that safe belief is not necessary for knowledge.
• Dretske, F. 1971. “Conclusive Reasons.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 49: 1-22.
  • In this paper Dretske argues for a sensitivity condition for knowledge.
• Gettier, E. 1963. “Is Justified True Belief Knowledge?” Analysis 23: 121-3.
  • Here the famous counterexamples to the justified true belief account of knowledge are presented.
• Goldman, A. 1967. “A Causal Theory of Knowing.” The Journal of Philosophy, 64 (12): 357-372.
  • Goldman presents a causal account of knowledge, which was an early attempt at solving the Gettier problem. Goldman later abounded this account in favor of his relevant alternatives account, a position he still maintains today.
• Goldman, A.  1976. “Discrimination and Perceptual Knowledge.” The Journal of Philosophy, 73: 771-91.
  • The relevant alternatives condition for knowledge is explicated and defended.
• Goldman, A. 1986. Epistemology and Cognition. USA: Harvard University Press.
  • A contemporary classic that presents Goldman’s epistemics—his multidisciplinary project of bringing the developments in cognitive psychology to bear on questions in individual and social epistemology.
• Goldman, A. 2007. “Philosophical Intuitions: Their Target, Their Source, and Their Epistemic Status.”  Grazer Philosophische Studien 74: 1-26.
  • In this paper Goldman discusses the place of intuition in philosophy and the epistemic status of such intuitions, which is currently a hot topic in epistemology.
• Greco, J. 2007. “Worries about Pritchard’s Safety.” Synthese 158: 299-302.
  • Problems for Pritchard’s safety condition are raised.
• Hawthorne, J. 2004. Knowledge and Lotteries. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • This is a masterful treatment of the lottery problem and includes a helpful comparative assessment of the various semantic solutions proposed to this problem.
• Hawthorne, J. & Gendler, T. 2005. “The Real Guide to Fake Barns.” Philosophical Studies 124: 331-352.
  • A humorous and pointed display of how some Gettier cases can be manipulated into yield even tougher cases for accounts of knowledge to handle.
• Hawthorne, J. & Lasonen-Aarnio, M. 2009. “Knowledge and Objective Chance”. In: Greenough, P. & Pritchard, D. (eds.). Williamson on Knowledge. Oxford: Oxford University Press, pp. 92-108.
  • In this piece the problematic relationship between safety and probability is identified.
• Lackey, J. 2006. “Pritchard’s Epistemic Luck.” Philosophical Quarterly 56: 284-9.
  • This author argues for inadequacies in Pritchard’s work on safety.
• Lewis, D. 1973. Counterfactuals. Oxford: Blackwell.
  • Here Lewis presents his modal semantics for counterfactuals.
• McGinn, C. 1999. “The Concept of Knowledge.” In: McGinn, C. Knowledge and Reality: Selected Essays. Oxford: Oxford University Press, pp. 7-35.
  • In this collection of his essays, McGinn defends his favored account of knowledge.
• Neta, R. & Rohrbaugh, G. “Luminosity and the Safety of Knowledge.” Pacific Philosophical Quarterly 85 (2004) 396–406.
  • Arguments against safety are presented.
• Nozick, R. 1981. Philosophical Explanations. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Chapter 3 contains Nozick’s defense of his sensitivity condition for knowledge.
• Peacocke, C. 1999. Being Known. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • In §7.5 Peacocke presents a useful elaboration of the notion of “could easily have.”
• Pritchard, D. 2005. Epistemic Luck. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • A masterful exposition of the place luck plays in epistemology.
• Pritchard, D. 2007. “Anti-Luck Epistemology.” Synthese 158: 277-98.
  • An argument for a refined safety condition for knowledge.
• Pritchard, D. 2008. “Knowledge, Luck, and Lotteries.” In: Hendricks, V. & Pritchard, D. (eds.). New Waves in Epistemology. London: Palgrave Macmillan, pp. 28-51.
  • Here Pritchard discusses the lottery problem for safety at length.
• Pritchard, D. 2009a. “Safety-Based Epistemology: Whither Now?” Journal of Philosophical Research 34: 33-45.
  • Further refinements of the safety condition.
• Pritchard, D. 2009b. Knowledge. London: Palgrave Macmillan
  • A general and accessible introduction to knowledge.
• Russell, B. 1948. Human Knowledge: Its Scope and its Limits. London: Allen & Unwin.
  • Here Russell lays out a general treatment of human knowledge part of which discusses his famous clock case.
• Sainsbury, R.M. 1997. “Easy Possibilities.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 57(4): 907-919.
  • A discussion of easy possibility with respect to S not easily falsely believing P.
• Shope, R. 1983. An Analysis of Knowing: A Decade of Research. Princeton: Princeton University Press.
  • A helpful overview of the early post-Gettier literature.
• Skyrms, F.B. 1967. “The Explication of ‘X knows that P’.” Journal of Philosophy 64: 373-89.
  • An early work in epistemology in the post-Gettier period.
• Sosa, E. 1999a. “How to Defeat Opposition to Moore.” Philosophical Perspectives 13: 141-54.
  • A discussion of safety in the context of skepticism.
• Sosa, E. 1999b. “How must knowledge be modally related to what is known?” Philosophical Topics 26 (1&2): 373-384.
  • Sosa argues that a contraposition of Nozick’s sensitivity condition of knowledge is a superior condition for knowledge.
• Sosa, E. 2007. A Virtue Epistemology: Apt Belief and Reflective Knowledge Volume I. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Sosa, E. 2009. Reflective Knowledge: Apt Belief and Reflective Knowledge Volume II. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • In these two publications Sosa develops and refines his work on safety into a virtue account of knowledge that does not lean so heavily on a “brute” safety condition for knowledge. As a result, Sosa (and Pritchard) can no longer be strictly labeled as a safety theorist. Indeed, Sosa is open to there being cases of lucky knowledge.
• Vogel, J. 1999. “The New Relative Alternative Theory”. Philosophical Perspectives 13: 155-80.
  • Here one finds, among other things, some interesting cases involving luck.
• Williamson, T. 1994. Vagueness. London: Routledge.
  • Here Williamson presents a  case for his epistemic conception of vagueness.
• Williamson, T. 2000. Knowledge and its Limits. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • A contemporary classic in epistemology in which Williamson argues for some rather iconoclastic positions about knowledge and evidence, among other important questions.
• Williamson, T. 2009a. “Reply to Cassam.” In: Greenough, P. & Pritchard, D. (eds.). Williamson on Knowledge. Oxford: Oxford University Press, pp. 285-292.
  • This is a collection of concerns several authors raise about various aspects of Williamson’s work in epistemology. The book concludes with Williamson’s replies.
• Williamson, T. 2009b. “Reply to Goldman.” In: Greenough, P. & Pritchard, D. (eds.). Williamson on Knowledge. Oxford: Oxford University Press, pp. 305-312.
• Williamson, T. 2009c. “Reply to John Hawthorne and Maria Lasonen-Aarnio.” In: Greenough, P. & Pritchard, D. (eds.). Williamson on Knowledge. Oxford: Oxford University Press, pp. 313-29.
• Williamson, T. 2009d. “Probability and Danger.” The Amherst Lecture in Philosophy.
  • A clarification of the relationship between safe belief and probability.

 

Author Information

Dani Rabinowitz
Email: dani.rabinowitz@philosophy.ox.ac.uk
Oxford University
United Kingdom