Victor Kraft (1880—1975)

Victor Kraft was an Austrian philosopher and librarian. He was, as he himself emphasized, a “non-orthodox” member of the Vienna Circle and tried to reintroduce scientific philosophy in Austria after the Second World War. Beginning in 1903, Kraft argued for epistemology based on ontological realism. He did not claim that realism can be proven logically but is established as an (abductive) inference in order to explain the regularities of perception. In the philosophy of science, he was a proponent of the hypothetico-deductive method. Interestingly, Kraft used a lot of illustrative examples from the sciences and humanities to substantiate his methodological claims. Kraft was the only member of the Vienna Circle who claimed, against logical-empiricist conviction, that an analysis of values and ethics are an appropriate subject for philosophical analysis. Also, he combined insights from empirical sciences (especially psychology) and philosophical analysis in order to provide a non-relativistic basis for morals. From a historical point of view, it is especially remarkable that Kraft published for over seven decades without abandoning his initial position. Of particular importance is his impact on Karl Popper and Paul Feyerabend. His most important works are his Erkenntnislehre (Theory of Knowledge, 1960), his Grundformen der wissenschaftlichen Methoden (The Basic Forms of the Scientific Method, 1925, second edition 1973) and his Foundations for a Scientific Analysis of Value (second German edition 1951, English version published in 1981). He is also known as the author of the seminal monograph The Vienna Circle: the Origin of Neo-Positivism (1951, published in English in 1969).

Table of Contents

1. Life
2. Work
   1. Epistemology and Ontology
   2. Philosophy of Science–Methodology
   3. Philosophy of Geography as an Example of Kraft’s Philosophy of Science
   4. Value Theory and Moral Philosophy
3. Kraft’s Impact as a Philosopher
4. References and Further Reading
   1. Selected Works by Kraft
   2. Quoted Literature and Suggestions for Further Reading

1. Life

Victor (or Viktor) Kraft was born on July 4, 1880 in Vienna, Austria. Both his father and his maternal grandfather were teachers. In 1899, he received the matura (the general qualification for university entrance) and enrolled in geography and history at the University of Vienna with the intention of becoming a teacher. There he attended lectures in economics, geology and botany. Kraft encountered philosophy for the first time as a member of the University of Vienna’s Philosophical Society and in private discussion circles. In 1903, Kraft completed his PhD thesis, “The Knowledge of the External World” (Die Erkenntnis der Außenwelt). The following year he studied under Wilhelm Dilthey, Georg Simmel, Carl Stumpf and Heinrich Wölfflin for one semester in Berlin. In 1914, he received the venia legendi, the right to teach at the university level, as a result of his book World-Concept and Knowledge-Concept (Weltbegriff und Erkenntnisbegriff). His supervisors for his “habilitation” were the psychologist and philosopher Friedrich Jodl and the philosopher Alois Höfler. Kraft’s original intention to pursue an academic career was regarded as futile by both Jodl and the philosopher Laurenz Müllner, which led Kraft to seek employment at the University of Vienna library. Though he held a full-time job, in which he ultimately reached the position of national librarian (Generalstaatsbibliothekar), he continued his work in philosophy. In 1924, he applied for a full professorship in Vienna, but for political reasons, the position was given to another candidate (Stadler 2001, 522 ff). Kraft received merely the title of associate professor. In the book he wrote for this application, The Basic Forms of the Scientific Method (Die Grundformen der wissenschaftlichen Methoden), which was published in 1925, Kraft outlined his hypothetico-deductive method. A second, completely revised edition was published in 1973.

In 1924, the Vienna Circle began as an informal discussion group led by the philosopher Moritz Schlick, and Kraft participated at these meetings. He was also a member of the so called Gomperz circle, which was named after its leader, the philosopher Heinrich Gomperz. Kraft never adhered to verificationism, the most radical thesis of the logical empiricists, because it was incompatible with his concept of realism. In 1937, he published Foundations for a Scientific Analysis of Values (Die Grundlagen einer wissenschaftlichen Wertlehre), a book which made early contributions to value theory and ethics. A second edition was released in 1951. In 1938, after the Anschluss (the occupation and annexation of Austria by Nazi Germany), a biographical caesura took place. Kraft was forced to retire due to the fact that he was married to a Jewish woman (Heiß 1993, 139, 157, n. 43; Topitsch 1981, xii). During World War II, he remained in his hometown of Vienna as an “inner emigrant” and wrote a manuscript that was lost in the final days of the war. During this time, he was able to publish in the Swedish journal Theoria. In 1947, he released Mathematics, Logic and Experience, a small volume based on the lost manuscript.

Kraft was finally reinstated as extraordinary professor in 1950, and at the age of seventy he received the title of ordentlicher Professor (full professor) at the University of Vienna. He tried to revitalize a kind of reformed logical empiricist philosophy but was unsuccessful; the political climate at that time was as hostile to logical-empirical philosophizing as it had been in the 1920s and 1930s. He became the academic head of a discussion group of students, which included Paul Feyerabend, who wrote his Ph.D. thesis under Kraft’s supervision. This group was part of the “Forum Alpach”, a non-profit organization that was most important for reintroducing scientific philosophy in Austria and Germany. Feyerabend served as the student leader of this group.

Kraft‘s most significant and mature monograph was published in 1960; the voluminous Theory of Knowledge (Erkenntnislehre) summarized his lifelong philosophical work, and he dedicated the book to himself on his eightieth birthday. Eight years later, he published a small book, The Fundamentals of Knowledge and of Morality (Die Grundlagen der Erkenntnis und der Moral). In 1974, Mathematics, Logic and Experience was reprinted in a substantially revised form. Kraft died on January 3, 1975, in Vienna. For Kraft’s biography see Kainz [1976].

2. Work

a. Epistemology and Ontology

The historical and thematic context in which Kraft developed his own philosophical position included the critique of immanence philosophy (a form of neutral monism developed by Richard Avenarius) and Ernst Mach’s positivism. Kraft was primarily concerned with defending the assumption of an external world. The Kantian (Critique of Pure Reason, B116) distinction between “question of fact” (quaestio facti) and “question of right” (quaestio iuris) was central for Kraft. In sharp contrast to any form of traditional Kantianism, Kraft did not intend to logically justify any answers to those “questions of right” but instead insisted on pragmatic vindication. This becomes remarkably clear in his attempts to stipulate the concept of knowledge, wherein only by presupposing some ends can an adequate normative definition of the concept of “knowledge” be reached. Kraft presupposes that knowledge must bear practical implications:

The only thing one can do is to make clear why a certain definition of knowledge is chosen, why those traits are regarded as essential for knowledge (Erkenntnis). These are not theoretical but practical claims of validity, which must be seen in the context of other ends, that is, that some consequences are preferred, or that some consequences or presuppositions are rejected (Kraft 1960, 31, my translation).

Later Kraft explains that the concept of knowledge is determined by human nature; that is, only a concept of knowledge that guarantees an invariant order of knowledge can be generally accepted. Human beings need information about the external world; otherwise, no orientation or human actions are possible. Hence, knowledge must be reliable, and it is reliable if it is not chaotic but ordered according to the laws of logic. Pragmatic utility is not enough; knowledge consists of invariant order (Kraft 1968, 17).

The same pattern can be found in his argumentation for a realistic ontology. Kraft states that he does not intend to logically prove the claim for the external world but maintains that the hypothesis of an external world is able to explain any inter- and intrasensual regularity. Examples of intersensual regularities would be: Every time you are served your favourite Indian curry, you recognize its taste and smell; you recognize your cell phone every time it rings. The latter is an example for an intrasensual regularity. In later years Kraft (Kraft 1968, 19) alludes to the infant’s psychological development to stress this point. In earlier years the same point was made without referring to developmental psychology (compare Kraft 1912, 60, 98 174, 181, 183; Kraft 1960, 115). An analogous argument can be constructed concerning the assumption of “other minds” (Fremdseelische). This is an inference to the best explanation. It is, however, not sufficient to simply postulate any explanatory hypothesis; it is also necessary to deduce regular experiential statements from this hypothesis. Kraft claims that his realism has advantages over  positivism because it is a “richer” position: one is able to use it to explain any form of inter- and intrasensual regularity, whereas the positivist must see a sheer miracle in this regularity (compare Kraft 1912, 168). He claims that the assumption of the existence of the external world is a condition for explaining experiential regularity.

It should be noted that Kraft’s starting point is the concept of “everyday realism;” it therefore lost some power in light of modern microphysics. As a consequence, he later emphasizes the subject’s perception of well-known objects (Kraft 1960, 321 f), such as a measuring instrument’s needle.

Any argument against abductive reasoning can be raised against Kraft. The objection that Kraft’s argument begs the question is especially important here; he starts with a realist’s assumption and tries to explicate the very same assumption. The skeptic (or positivist) cannot be convinced theoretically, and therefore, Kraft relies on praxis. Here, he turns the tables; it is not the realist who has to justify his claim but the positivist because the latter violates our commonly accepted principles of abductive reasoning.

b. Philosophy of Science–Methodology

Kraft’s epistemology cannot be separated from his methodology; his aim is to explicate the epistemological assumptions of any human cognitive practice. Science especially must be emphasized here because it notably fulfills the epistemological requirements mentioned above. It is useful to discuss Kraft’s philosophy of science by asking four questions:

1. What is a (scientific) theory for Kraft?
2. Why, for Kraft, does any theory have mere hypothetical validity?
3. How can the theory’s axioms be reached?
4. How is a theory anchored in experience?

Question 1: What is a (scientific) theory for Kraft?

Kraft adheres to the classical notion of a theory as a “deductive system” (Kraft, 1925, 126; 1960, 369 f). Explanation is deduction from axioms (Kraft 1912, 175). This notion was elaborated by Carl Hempel (see Theories of Explanation, sect. 2).

Question 2: Why, for Kraft, does any theory have mere hypothetical validity?

The answer is simple. Any theory contains sentences of a general nature, for example, “All bodies fall to earth.” This generalization can only be regarded as a hypothesis because it does not follow logically from single instances of falling bodies (problem of induction). This classical, logical uncertainty is supplemented by pragmatic underdetermination. In short, if several aims or concepts of knowledge are possible, as we have seen, how can the correctness of the chosen one be established? Thus, the answers to the first two questions can be conveniently labeled “hypothetico-deductivism.”

Question 3: How can the theory’s axioms be reached?

To begin with, there is an important distinction to keep in mind: “axioms” is Kraft’s wording; today, one would use the term “hypotheses”. Kraft’s use of words is not modified here for expository reasons. He mentions several times that any deduction is only valid if the axioms are accepted. The axioms are not freely chosen but are accepted on the basis of whether they could fulfill an explanatory task (Kraft, 1925, 157; 1947, 96 f). Given this, a hypothetical system can be established rationally because Kraft argues that the “immanent order of experience” guides the postulation of the axioms (Kraft 1947, 96 f). He claims that this order is sought because it guarantees technical and theoretical control of experiential facts (Erlebnistatsachen). In other words, experience guides the postulation of axioms in an unambiguous manner.

Axioms are postulates. In any kind of scientific research, they are the product of scientific genius and intuition or scintillation. Therefore, they cannot be explained and analyzed further. On the other hand, those very axioms must fulfill a practical task, for example, the explanation of inter- and intrasensual regularities. Immediately the question arises of what explanation consists in, because any set of axioms which does not fulfill its explanatory task cannot be regarded as practically relevant. Consequently, if those axioms in question do not provide the logical starting point for an explanatory deduction of the above mentioned regularities, they must be dismissed as practically irrelevant. Logical deduction, according to Kraft, is the standard form of a (scientific) explanation and science provides knowledge. Therefore, in order to establish the fundamental axioms of any form of (scientific) knowledge, one must refer to a basic or embryonic notion of (scientific) knowledge. In a nutshell, in order to establish knowledge one must already have knowledge. Although Kraft is aware of this so called “circle of epistemology” (a claim made by the German philosopher Leonard Nelson early in 1911, compare Kraft, 1960, 1 ff) his solution is not satisfactory because a conventional fixation of the term in question must be either arbitrary, hence irrational – a solution which is rejected by Kraft – or guided by rational philosophical argumentation. If the latter is the case, one begs the question, assuming that “rationality” is explicated at least partly by (logical) consistency of the propositions in question. This remarkable tension is overlooked by Kraft. The charge of circularity lurks again under the surface of his argumentation because Kraft claims that the axioms are chosen in order to be empirically applicable. However, this is problematic because counter-instances are excluded, and the very idea of falsification of a theory becomes questionable. Experience would lose its power as a corrective instance.

Question 4: How is a theory anchored in experience?

Kraft is an empiricist; that is, he sees the basis of any knowledge-claim in experience. Its foundation lies not in a pure atomistic “sense-datum” or any sensualistic equivalent. Instead, the sense-datum is embedded in an experiential complex that consists of experiential relations (Wahrnehmungsbeziehungen). Moreover, experiential relations are interpreted as signs for external objects. As a consequence, statements about those “external objects” can be tested because any statement about a mind-independent object implies existential statements as logical consequences. Kraft claimed that there is isomorphism between the class of existential statements (implied by the assumption of a mind-independent object) and the experiential regularity. (If there is no table in my room, neither you nor I will be able to perceive it; I will not be able to perceive any intrasensual, intersensual or intersubjective regularity.)

Given tables, flowers and honey bees as ordinary objects, no problems will arise. However, what will happen if electrons, quarks or other highly theoretical entities enter the stage? The layman will perhaps see nothing and will not be able to construct any regularities. To be sure, one is able to learn to “see” those theoretical regularities, but once again, Kraft seems to dismiss the role of dissent in science. He establishes the concept of a “well-known object,” a class of objects about which no dissent might arise. Researcher Miller “sees” electrons, researcher Smith sees another theoretical entity, but both see a screen. (This is a corollary to the idea of the theory-ladenness of observation.) It should be kept in mind, that the term “theory-ladenness” can be understood in two ways (Heidelberger, 2003, 138 f). First, it is the notion that perception is based on expectations and beliefs, hence no “neutral” sense-data is given. Second, “theory-ladennes” is a semantical notion: every (scientific) term gets its meaning through a (scientific) theory. Kraft rejects the second notion, and adheres to the first one: It is a matter of fact that there are no “neutral” sense data. In his earlier years, however, he makes this point without explicitly referring to psychology but admits that the idea of an objective external world is a necessary prerequisite for any rational construction of knowledge.

To summarize, Kraft argued for the assumption of an external world in order to explain perceptual regularities. The empirical basis is equivalent to “experiential relations,” which implies the assumption of the external world. Only because of this is one able to formulate fertile predictions and exclude metaphysical or theistic (pseudo-)explanations. The most important criticism that can be raised against Kraft’s attempt is that it is circular: he argued abductively for realism in order to exclude any form of idealism, solipsism or positivism. This maneuver begins with perceived regularities that demand explanation; however, these very regularities are the basis for his empiricist philosophy of science. Kraft rejected any other (pseudo-)explanation of these regularities. He upholds realism as an inference to the best explanation, and in so doing, he was able to formulate a criterion for rejecting non-realistic interpretations of regularity. Hence, his ontology and philosophy of science are entangled, to say the least. This reveals once again that the postulation of axioms cannot be a free decision but is at least partly guided by meta-theoretical considerations and leads quite naturally to Kraft’s moral philosophy, especially because the concept of knowledge is regarded as a normative concept.

c. Philosophy of Geography as an Example of Kraft’s Philosophy of Science

Kraft was not only a philosopher; he was also trained in geography. He studied under Albrecht Penck, an outstanding geographer who specialized in physical geography and geomorphology. Penck was influenced by William Morris Davis, an American geographer famous for the “cycle of erosion,” an explicitly deductive theory of geomorphological change. It can be argued that Kraft developed his methodology in part as a result of his association with Penck.

1914 and fifteen years later (1929a), Kraft wrote introductory treatises for students of geography that focused on methodology. As a discipline, geography was (at least in German-speaking countries) in an uncertain state. Is geography a generalizing science or merely descriptive? Is its object the need to simply describe the earth’s surface or should it also tackle the laws governing the changes that take place there, for example as a result of erosion?

Kraft stresses that this “double dualism” is the reason for the not-yet-settled scientific status of geography. The following table illustrates these challenges:

In this conundrum, Kraft took a generally “nomothetical” stance. That is, scientific explanation is deducing singular statements from general laws. Even if the aim is descriptive, some universal laws must be presupposed because every scientific description works with concepts of type. However, this is not the whole story. Kraft sees in abductive inferences to universal laws an important task for general geography (Kraft 1929a, 14). His use of the term “induction” is ambiguous; “abductive” would fit much better, because he did not refer to a merely enumerative induction. Such an “inductive inference” therefore presupposes hypothetical assumptions (Kraft 1925, 250f); only then can universal laws be postulated. These hypotheses can in turn be tested by deducing predictions. To summarize, “induction is not more than postulating a hypotheses and is not an epistemological procedure (Erkenntnisverfahren) on its own” (Kraft 1960, 257).

Description is important too. Descriptive geography presupposes universal laws, whereas general geography presupposes scientific description. The result of Kraft’s analysis is that the more fundamental epistemological dualism in geography cannot be bridged because there are two different epistemological aims—generalizing and describing—that cannot be reduced. However, this chasm must not be regarded as an ontological gap. The praxis of geography illustrates that human and physical geography need each other.

Finally, Kraft mentioned a holistic approach that was in fashion during the 1920s. The idea was that a landscape (Landschaft) could be grasped intuitively, much like a work of art is apprehended. According to Kraft, this “third way” is not scientific because a “synthetic approach” lacks any criteria to rationalize the material. Both treaties had some impact. The first (1914) led to a short correspondence between Kraft and the eminent German geographer Alfred Hettner. Fred K. Schaefer used the latter (1929a) to support his critique of Richard Hartshorne, who followed Hettner in some respects.

The “Schaefer-Hartshorne Debate” was the central methodological controversy in geography in the 1950s (compare Martin 1989). It followed the nomothetic-idiographic debate and helped to clarify the scientific status of the study of geography. (Basically, it was the aftermath of the old nomothetic-idiographic controversy.) Kraft developed the idea that any special epistemological status for geography as a science cannot be argued for, which was a straightforward rejection of Hettner’s approach. This is not surprising given the main tenets of logical empiricism, but researchers tend to overlook that Kraft came to his conclusion by dwelling on the (Kantian) distinction between “questions of fact” and “questions of right”. As a methodologist, Kraft proposes a unitarian or non-dualistic approach, and as an epistemologist, he refers to different aims of geography; in his view, geography’s basic aims are either individualistic or generalizing. (For further reading, see Radler, 2008.)

Although Kraft’s analysis of geography is of rather special interest for students of (general) philosophy of science, one can show that Kraft’s basic ideas can also be found in his criticism of the Verstehen approach in the humanities (compare Kraft 1929b). An intuitive grasping of a text’s meaning is rejected by Kraft with the same arguments he proposed against the grasping of the “essence” of a landscape. Besides, in his analysis of the methodology of historiography Kraft makes remarkably clear that the former cannot proceed without some nomothetical laws. At least implicitly, the historians have to refer to causal laws or statistical regularities if they aim to explain the behavior of an historical individual or group. The same holds for the philologist who wants to classify a historical document.

d. Value Theory and Moral Philosophy

In his value theory and moral philosophy, Kraft distinguishes between (a) value concepts, (b) value judgments and (c) the rational justification of morals. His Foundations for a Scientific Analysis of Value contains an extensive chapter about the psychology of value judgment.

(a) Value concepts.

Kraft’s primary aim is conceptual clarification and analysis. For example, consider the following statement: “Lassie is a loyal and healthy dog.” The subject Lassie is the bearer of value (Wertträger)—a good. The example can be generalized: a loyal or healthy dog is a good, a bearer of value. The adjectives “loyal” and “healthy” in the statement are value predicates. “Loyalty” and “health” are, according to Kraft, values. Values are the intension (Bedeutungsgehalt) of a value concept. Hence, values designate a general relation to a range of things; a comrade, a friend or a partner can be loyal as well. Thus, the bearer of value may change. In a corollary analysis, Kraft shows that the value concept can be divided into two components. First, it can be divided into a factual component, and second, it can be divided into a normative component (Wertcharakter). (A similar distinction was later made by R. M. Hare.) What does this mean? Consider the value “loyalty.” A loyal friend, comrade or dog may have some factual traits in common. One might argue that a specific form of subservient and respectful behavior might be called “loyal”. These factual traits become more evident if one considers “technical norms;” for example, it is easy to explain what a good tool is. Finally, consider the value “beauty.” Its factual component can be described as a harmonic relationship of the parts of a whole and therein lies its beauty (compare Aesthetics, especially sect. 3). The normative component denotes the value character that, generally speaking, signifies a distinction (Auszeichnung). A loyal dog is preferred over a dog that is disobedient; a masterful painting is preferred over a smearing of paint on a train station’s wall. It is this normative, distinctive component that is essential for value concepts. A large part of Kraft’s analysis consists in describing psychological investigations, or how the subject acquired the value component psychologically.

Valuations do not consist, according to Kraft, in their relation to emotions. Emotions merely cause valuations. An attitude or disposition to these emotions must be added, a normative stance to these emotions must be taken. An analysis of valuation must consider this attitude or disposition but must not be exhausted in the inquiry into emotions or feelings. Therefore, an equation of valuation and emotional affection or disaffection is ruled out. Of course, psychological aspects and problems enter the stage immediately if one analyzes the normative stance to relational feelings or emotions. It becomes clear here that Kraft abandoned the notion of purely semantic and syntactical consideration. Based on his assumptions and his conception of philosophy, it is not possible to analyze valuation without including empirical findings.

(b) Value judgments.

The distinction (Auszeichnung), the essential component of a value concept, can be explained psychologically. Its acquisition is an individual process. However, this is irrelevant in normative considerations because moral philosophy cannot, according to Kraft, be reduced to the description of psychological processes. Value judgments must be impersonal (Kraft, 1981, 129 ff). Kraft distinguishes between value judgments as propositions concerning actual determination of attitudes and value judgments that can be described as imperatives. Value judgments as propositions about actual determination of attitudes would be labeled as descriptive ethics today. The problem is that such a position cannot guarantee objectivity, insofar as moral relativism is regarded as fact:

General human structure as such is not sufficient to determine valuations unequivocally, and given individual differences between evaluations, we cannot in principle exclude the possibility that the same aspect of the same object maybe appraised differently by different persons. (Kraft, 1981, 137).

Kraft therefore offers value judgments as imperatives, as “general guidelines” (Kraft, 1981, 138 ff).

(c) The rational justification of morals.

For this reason, the very problem is that given the empirical findings that guided Kraft’s analysis of values and value judgments, how it is possible to establish an objective (and not merely subjective) moral (compare Kraft 1981, 142 ff)? Is a form of moral relativism not the unavoidable consequence of Kraft’s analysis? From the 1940s on, Kraft began to confront this problem. His main contribution to practical philosophy is an explication of objective morality in a form of the following argument, which can be generalized by substituting “we” for “I” (see also Radler 2010):

I (we) have desires which I am (we are) eager to satisfy.
If I (we) accept morality, I (we) could satisfy my (our) desires.
I (we) accept morality.

Kraft asserts that due to general human organization (allgemein menschliche Organisation), some basic valuations must be valid in every culture (Kraft 1981, 173). In his last monograph, “basic human organization” is not the reference point but rather the (even more vague) concept of “culture”, which is important for an individual’s morality:

Culture is not solely a means to reach happiness, culture is the manner in which humans live. Therefore, culture has to be human’s highest aim, regardless of whether culture makes men happier or not. Humans can only seek to induce happiness through culture” (Kraft, 1968, 141).

Hence, “[culture] is the means, to devise one’s life. Therefore the imperative to guide one’s life through culture is categorical” (Kraft, 1968, 143).

From a social point of view, morality can, according to Kraft, only be instrumentally argued for. He regarded the imperatives of social morality as necessary conditions for reaching aims decreed by human nature.

Kraft was aware of the problems inherent in this kind of reasoning. First, in social morality, only “hypothetical imperatives” can be formulated. The crucial question is how to deal with the apparent plurality of aims and means. Second, it is doubtful whether the conditional sentence in the premises formulates a necessary and sufficient condition. Third, Kraft was criticized because this position is circular; an unspecified moral stance must be taken, and morality is only binding for those who already have accepted its binding force. Kraft is therefore not able to convince those who are “moral outsiders.” His work was an attempt to clarify the cryptic normative inclinations of moral individuals. Kraft’s approach resembles “natural law” positions.

3. Kraft’s Impact as a Philosopher

Looking back one can summarize Kraft’s philosophy as empirically informed (naturalistic), anti-inductivistic, anti-relativistic and – on the other hand – anti-dogmatic. In this way, he is an adherent of “scientific philosophy.” To be more precise, Kraft’s philosophy is remarkable in several aspects: First, “inferences to the best explanations” are scattered throughout the entirety of his work, from epistemology to moral philosophy. Second, Kraft formulates his arguments on the basis of specific empirical findings and a metaphysical (ontological) position. It has also become clear that ontology, epistemology, methodology, value theory and moral philosophy are entangled. At the very center of his philosophical ideas stands the notion that “knowledge” must be regarded as a normative concept. It is this understanding of philosophy, an adherence to prescriptions and not only formal reconstruction, which is central for Kraft.

His bearing on the philosophy of geography was already mentioned. Far more importance seems to be his influence on Karl Popper (compare Schramm 1992, 135f). Popper admits that Kraft can be regarded as a forerunner of his deductivism, however Kraft criticized Popper where the latter argues for a kind of platonistic metaphysics, that is his world 3 (Kraft 1976). Besides this, Kraft criticized Popper’s contribution to the so called “protocol sentence debate”. With his critique of Hugo Dingler, a proponent of conventionalism, Kraft influenced Hans Albert, the leading adherent of Critical Rationalism in Germany. Since the late twentieth century, Kraft’s impact on Paul Feyerabend has been under investigation. It is significant that under Kraft’s guidance a discussion circle of young students in the 1950s in Vienna was established. This circle provided Feyerabend the platform for discussing his PhD-thesis, which is basically a post-war prolongation of the “protocol sentence debate.” Perhaps the most important impact of Kraft’s thinking on Feyerabend is his later admission that philosophy (of science) is empirically informed but basically grounded on pragmatically chosen principles. (The problems of this point were discussed in section 2b above.)

4. References and Further Reading

Most works by Kraft have not been translated into English. The two exceptions are Foundations for a Scientific Analysis of Value (1981) and The Vienna Circle, the origin of neo-positivism; a chapter in the history of recent philosophy (1969). Kraft’s most important works are Erkenntnislehre (Theory of Knowledge) (1960) and Die Grundformen der wissenschaftlichen Methoden (The Basic Forms of Scientific Methods) (1925). The only secondary sources in English are Topitsch (1981), Stadler (2001, 159-161; 666-673) and the review by Feyerabend (1962/1963) of Kraft’s Erkenntnislehre (1960). Kainz (1976) is the standard and still unsurpassed reference to Kraft’s life. For a complete bibliography, see Stadler (2001, 667-671) or Frey (1975a and 1975b).

Readers who are familiar with German might consult the following references. Radler (2006, 2008, 2010) provides a historical reconstruction and philosophical analysis of Kraft’s philosophy; Vollbrecht (2004)  and Siegetsleitner (2014, 332-386) investigate his moral philosophy. Short and concise overviews are given by Rutte (1973), Frey (1975a and 1976b), Haller (1976) and Schramm (1992). Stadler (2001, 522ff) describes Kraft’s difficulties with securing a professorship in the 1920s. Reininger (1938 [ed.]; compare Stadler, 2001, 158) provides an overview of the “Philosophical Society of the University of Vienna”. Feyerabend (1982, 108f) mentions the Forum Alpbach and Kraft as an important influence. The above mentioned traces of Kraft’s philosophy can – for example –  be found in Feyerabend (1958/1981, 34n; 1960/1999, 42; 1972/1999, 158n). Kraft’s modified Kantian argumentation becomes most visible in his early works (compare Kraft, 1904; 1912). Kraft’s papers on philosophy and methodology of geography are discussed in Radler (2008), where one can also find relevant details and references to secondary literature. Hacohen (2002, 236) describes Popper’s friendly relationship to Kraft. Radler (2006), Kuby (2010) and Stadler (2010) focus on his relationship to Popper and Feyerabend. Kraft’s criticism of Dingler and conventionalism can be found in (1947). Kraft discusses aspects of physicalism and phenomenalism in (1969), readers who are interested in the “protocol sentence debate” in general should compare Kraft’s reconstruction with Uebel (2007).

a. Selected Works by Kraft

• Kraft, Victor (1904), “Das Problem der Aussenwelt.” In Archiv für Philosophie. II. Abt.: Archiv für systematische Philosophie, N.F. X, 269-313.
• Kraft, Victor (1912), Weltbegriff und Erkenntnisbegriff. Eine erkenntnistheoretische Untersuchung. Leipzig: Johann Ambrosius Barth.
• Kraft, Victor (1914), “Gegenstand, Aufgaben und Methoden der Geographie als Wissenschaft.” In O. Kende (ed.), Handbuch der geographischen Wissenschaften, 1^st part. Berlin: Vossische Buchhandlung [= Sammlung wissenschaftlicher Handbücher für Studierende I], 1-8.
• Kraft, Victor (1925), Die Grundformen der wissenschaftlichen Methoden. Vienna /Leipzig: Hölder-Pichler-Tempsky A.-G. [= Österreichische Akademie der Wissenschaften, Philosophisch-historische Klasse 203, Abh. 3].
• Kraft, Victor (1929a), “Die Geographie als Wissenschaft.” In F. Lampe (ed.) Enzyklopädie der Erdkunde, 1^st part: Methodenlehre der Geographie. Leipzig / Vienna: Franz Deuticke: 1-22.
• Kraft, Victor (1929b), “Intuitives Verstehen in der Geschichtswissenschaft.” In W. Bauer (ed.), Mitteilungen des Österreichischen Instituts für Geschichtsforschung, Suplementary Volume XI, Innsbruck: Universitäts-Verlag Wagner, 1-30.
• Kraft, Victor (1940b), “Über Moralbegründung.” In Theoria 6, 191-226.
• Kraft, Victor (1947), Mathematik, Logik und Erfahrung. Vienna: Springer.
• Kraft, Victor (1951/1937), Die Grundlagen einer wissenschaftlichen Wertlehre. 2^nd ed. Vienna: Springer.
• Kraft, Victor (1955), “Der Wissenschaftscharakter der Erkenntnislehre.” In Actes du deuxième congrès international de l’union de philosophie des sciences. Neuchatel: Èditions du Griffon I, 85-94.
• Kraft, Victor (1960), Erkenntnislehre. Vienna: Springer.
• Kraft, Victor (1967/1950), Einführung in die Philosophie. Philosophie, Weltanschauung, Wissenschaft. 2^nd ed. Vienna / New York: Springer.
• Kraft, Victor (1968), Die Grundlagen der Erkenntnis und der Moral. Berlin: Duncker & Humblot.
• Kraft, Victor (1969), The Vienna Circle : the origin of neo-positivism ; a chapter in the history of recent philosophy. – Reprinted. – New York, NY: Greenwood Press.
• Kraft, Victor (1973/1925), Die Grundformen der wissenschaftlichen Methoden, Vienna: Verlag der Österreichischen Akademie der Wissenschaften [= Österreichische Akademie der Wissenschaften. Philosophisch-historische Klasse 284, Abh. 5]. 2^nd ed. Vienna: Verl. d. Österreich. Akad. d. Wiss.
• Kraft, Victor (1973a), “Konstruktiver Realismus.” In Zeitschrift für allgemeine Wissenschaftstheorie 4, 313-322.
• Kraft, Victor (1973b), “Gespräch mit Viktor Kraft.” In Conceptus, 7 (21-23), 9-25.
• Kraft, Victor (1974), “Popper and the Vienna Circle.” In P. A. Schilpp (ed.), The Philosophy of Karl Popper [= Library of Living Philosophers XIV]. La Salle, Ill.: Open Court, 185-205.
• Kraft, Victor (1976), “Das Universalienproblem.” In B. Kanitscheider (ed.), Sprache und Erkenntnis. Festschrift für Gerhard Frey zum 60. Geburtstag. Innsbruck: Amoe, 33-36.
• Kraft, Victor (1981), Foundations for a scientific analysis of value. Ed. by Henk L. Mulder. Transl. by Elizabeth Hughes Schneewind. With an introd. by Ernst Topitsch. Dordrecht, Holland [u.a.]: Reidel.
• Kraft, Victor (1997/1951), Der Wiener Kreis. Der Ursprung des Neopositivismus. 3^rd ed. Vienna / New York: Springer.

b. Quoted Literature and Suggestions for Further Reading

• Feyerabend, Paul (1962/63), “Erkenntnislehre, By Viktor Kraft” [Review], In The British Journal for the Philosophy of Science 8, 319-323.
• Feyerabend, Paul (1981/1958), “An attempt at a realistic interpretation of experience.” In P. K.  Feyerabend, Realism, rationalism and scientific method. Philosophical Papers. Vol. 1, Cambridge et al.: Cambridge University Press, 17-37.
• Feyerabend, Paul (1982), Science in Free Society. London: Verso.
• Feyerabend, Paul (1999/1960), “The problem of the existence of theoretical entities.” In P. K. Feyerabend, Knowledge, Science and Relativism. Philosophical Papers Vol. 3. Ed. by John Preston. Cambridge et al.: Cambridge University Press, 16-50.
• Feyerabend, Paul (1999/1972), “On the limited validity of methodological rules.” In P. K. Feyerabend, Knowledge, Science and Relativism. Philosophical Papers Vol. 3. Ed. by John Preston. Cambridge et al.: Cambridge University Press, 138-181.
• Frey, Gerhard (1975a), “Logik, Erfahrung und Norm. Zum Tode Victor Krafts.” In Zeitschrift für allgemeine Wissenschaftstheorie 6, 1-6.
• Frey, Gerhard (1975b), “Nachträge und Ergänzungen zur Bibliographie der Schriften von Victor Kraft.” In Zeitschrift für allgemeine Wissenschaftstheorie 6, 179-181.
• Hacohen, Malachi Haim (2000), Karl Popper – The Formative Years 1902-1945. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Haller, Rudolf (1976), “Nachruf auf Victor Kraft.” In Zeitschrift für philosophische Forschung 30, 618-622.
• Heidelberger, Michael (2003), “Theory Ladennes and Scientific Instruments in Experimentation.” In Hans Radder (ed.), The Philosophy of Scientific Experimentation. Pittsburgh: University of Pittsburgh Press, 138-151.
• Heiß, Gernot (1993), “… wirkliche Möglichkeiten für eine nationalsozialistische Philosophie? Die Reorganisation der Philosophie (Psychologie und Pädagogik) in Wien 1938 bis 1940.” In Kurt R. Fischer & F, M. Wimmer (eds.), Der geistige Anschluß. Philosophie und Politik an der Universität Wien 1930-1950. Vienna: WUV-Universitätsverlag, 130-170.
• Kainz, Friedrich (1976), “Viktor Kraft [Nachruf].” In Almanach für das Jahr 1975 [der Österreichischen Akademie der Wissenschaften], 519-557.
• Kuby, Daniel (2010), “Rational zu sein war damals für uns eine Lebensfrage.” Studien zu Paul Feyerabends Wiener Lehrjahren. Diploma thesis, University of Vienna.
• Martin, Geoffrey (1989), “The Nature of Geography and the Schaefer-Hartshorne Debate.” In J. N. Entrikin & S. D. Brunn (eds.), Reflections on Richard Hartshorne’s The Nature of Geography,Washington, DC: Assoc. of American Geographers 69-89.
• Radler, Jan (2006), Victor Krafts konstruktiver Empirismus. Eine historische und philosphische Untersuchung. Berlin: Logos.
• Radler, Jan (2008), “Victor Kraft und die Geographie.” In M.Fürst et al. (eds.), Analysen, Argumente, Ansätze. Beiträge zum 8. Internationalen Kongress der Österreichischen Gesellschaft für Philosophie in Graz, II. Frankfurt (Main): Ontos, 65-75.
• Radler, Jan (2010), “Abduktive Argumentationsformen in Krafts Moraltheorie.” In A. Siegetsleitner (ed), Logischer Empirismus, Werte und Moral. Eine Neubewertung. Vienna / New York: Springer, 157-176.
• Reininger, Robert (1938, ed.), “50 Jahre Philosophische Gesellschaft an der Universität Wien 1888-1938.” Vienna: Verlag der Philosophischen Gesellschaft an der Universität Wien.
• Rutte, Heiner (1973), “VIKTOR KRAFT. Eine philosophische Standortbestimmung.” In Conceptus 7, 5-8.
• Schramm, Alfred (1992), “Viktor Kraft: Konstruktiver Realismus.” In J. Speck (ed.), Die Grundprobleme der großen Philosophen. Philosophie der Neuzeit, VI (Tarski, Reichenbach, Kraft, Gödel, Neurath). Göttingen: Vandenhoek & Ruprecht, 110-137.
• Siegetsleitner, Anne (2014), Ethik und Moral im Wiener Kreis Zur Geschichte eines engagierten Humanismus. Vienna / Cologne / Weimar: Böhlau.
• Stadler, Friedrich (2001), The Vienna Circle. Studies in the Origins, Development, and Influence of Logical Empiricism. Wien / New York: Springer.
• Stadler, Friedrich (2010), “Paul Feyerabend and the Forgotten ‘Third Vienna Circle’.” In F. Stadler (ed.), Vertreibung, Transformation und Rückkehr der Wissenschaftstheorie. Vienna /Berlin / Münster: Lit, 169-189.
• Topitsch, Ernst (1981), “Introduction” In Victor Kraft, Foundations for a Scientific Analysis of Value, ed. by Henk Mulder. Dordrecht / Boston / London: Reidel [Vienna Circle Collection 15], xi-xvii.
• Uebel, Thomas (2007), Empiricism at the Crossroads. The Vienna Circle’s Protocol-Sentence Debate. Chicago / La Salle, Ill.: Open Court.
• Vollbrecht, Oliver (2004), Victor Kraft: rationale Normenbegründung und logischer Empirismus: eine philosophische Studie. Munich: Utz.

Author Information

Jan Radler
Email: jan.radler@web.de
European University Viadrina Frankfurt (Oder)
Germany

Émile Durkheim (1858—1917)

Émile Durkheim was a French sociologist who rose to prominence in the late 19^th and early 20^th centuries. Along with Karl Marx and Max Weber, he is credited as being one of the principal founders of modern sociology. Chief among his claims is that society is a sui generis reality, or a reality unique to itself and irreducible to its composing parts. It is created when individual consciences interact and fuse together to create a synthetic reality that is completely new and greater than the sum of its parts. This reality can only be understood in sociological terms, and cannot be reduced to biological or psychological explanations. The fact that social life has this quality would form the foundation of another of Durkheim’s claims, that human societies could be studied scientifically. For this purpose he developed a new methodology, which focuses on what Durkheim calls “social facts,” or elements of collective life that exist independently of and are able to exert an influence on the individual. Using this method, he published influential works on a number of topics. He is most well known as the author of On the Division of Social Labor, The Rules of Sociological Method, Suicide, and The Elementary Forms of Religious Life. However, Durkheim also published a voluminous number of articles and reviews, and has had several of his lecture courses published posthumously.

When Durkheim began writing, sociology was not recognized as an independent field of study. As part of the campaign to change this he went to great lengths to separate sociology from all other disciplines, especially philosophy. In consequence, while Durkheim’s influence in the social sciences has been extensive, his relationship with philosophy remains ambiguous. Nevertheless, Durkheim maintained that sociology and philosophy are in many ways complementary, going so far as to say that sociology has an advantage over philosophy, since his sociological method provides the means to study philosophical questions empirically, rather than metaphysically or theoretically. As a result, Durkheim often used sociology to approach topics that have traditionally been reserved for philosophical investigation.

For the purposes of this article, Durkheim’s strictly sociological thought will be set aside to allow his contributions to philosophy to take prominence. These fall largely in the realms of the philosophy of religion, social theory, the philosophy of social science, hermeneutics, the philosophy of language, morality, metaethics, political theory, and epistemology. Durkheim’s deconstruction of the self, as well as his analysis of the crisis brought on by modernity and his projections about the future of Western civilization, also deserve significant consideration.

Table of Contents

1. Biography
   1. Life
   2. Intellectual Development and Influences
   3. Reception of Durkheim’s Thought
2. The Sociological Method: Society and the Study of Social Facts
   1. Durkheim’s Social Realism
3. Durkheim’s Sociology of Knowledge
   1. Représentations Collectives
   2. Durkheim’s Philosophy of Language
   3. The Categories
   4. The Classification of Knowledge
   5. Cultural Relativism versus Scientific Truth
   6. Conclusion
4. Durkheim’s Philosophy of Religion
5. Durkheim on Morality
6. Social Change and Modernity in the West
   1. Causes of Social Change
   2. The Division of Labor and the Emergence of Modernity in Europe
   3. The Death of the Gods
   4. The Cult of the Individual: Durkheim and Politics
7. The Individual and Society
8. References and Further Reading
   1. Selection of Durkheim’s Works in French
   2. Selection of Durkheim’s Works in English
   3. Secondary Sources

1. Biography

a. Life

David Émile Durkheim was born in April 1858 in Épinal, located in the Lorraine region of France. His family was devoutly Jewish, and his father, grandfather, and great grandfather were all rabbis. Durkheim, however, broke with tradition and went to the École normale supérieure in 1879, where he studied philosophy. He graduated in 1882 and began teaching the subject in France. In 1887 he was appointed to teach Social Sciences and Pedagogy at the University of Bordeaux, allowing him to teach the first ever official sociology courses in France. Also in 1887, Durkheim married Louise Dreyfus, with whom he would eventually have two children. During his time at Bordeaux, Durkheim had great success, publishing his doctoral thesis On the Division of Social Labor (1893, Division), The Rules of Sociological Method (1895, Rules), and Suicide: A Study in Sociology (1897, Suicide). In 1896 he established the prestigious Année sociologique, further cementing sociology’s place in the academic world.

In 1902, Durkheim was finally given a promotion in the form of the chair of the Science of Education at the Sorbonne. In 1906 he became a full professor and in 1913, his position was changed to formally include sociology. Henceforth he was chair of the Science of Education and Sociology. Here he gave lectures on a number of subjects and published a number of important essays as well as his final, and most important, major work The Elementary Forms of Religious Life (1912, Forms). The outbreak of World War I would prove to have disastrous consequences for Durkheim. The war took many of his most promising pupils and in 1915 his son, André, also died in combat. From this Durkheim would never recover and in November 1917 he died of a stroke, leaving his last great work, La Morale (Morality), with only a preliminary introduction.

During his lifetime, Durkheim was politically engaged, yet kept these engagements rather discrete. He defended Alfred Dreyfus during the Dreyfus affair and was a founding member of the Human Rights League. Durkheim was familiar with Karl Marx’s ideas. Yet, Durkheim was very critical of Marx’s work, which he saw as unscientific and dogmatic, as well as of Marxism, which he saw as needlessly conflictual, reactionary, and violent. Nevertheless, he supported a number of socialist reforms, and had a number of important socialist friends, but never committed himself to a political party and did not make political issues a primary concern. Despite his muted political engagement, Durkheim was an ardent patriot of France. He hoped to use his sociology as a way to help a French society suffering under the strains of modernity, and during World War I he took up a position writing anti-German propaganda pamphlets, which in part use his sociological theories to help explain the fervent nationalism found in Germany.

b. Intellectual Development and Influences

Durkheim was not the first thinker to attempt to make sociology a science. Auguste Comte, who wished to extend the scientific method to the social sciences, and Herbert Spencer, who developed an evolutionary utilitarian approach that he applied to different areas in the social sciences, made notable attempts and their work had a formative influence on Durkheim. In particular, Durkheim appropriated elements of Comte’s positivism as well as elements of his scientific approach to studying societies. Durkheim’s analysis of the ways in which different parts of society operate to create a functioning whole, as well as his use of the organic analogy, was in many ways inspired by Spencer’s own brand of functionalist analysis. However, Durkheim was critical of these attempts at sociology and felt that neither had sufficiently divorced their analyses from metaphysical assumptions. These were to be found particularly in what Durkheim considered Comte and Spencer’s unilinear models of social development, which were based on a priori laws of social evolution. While Durkheim incorporated elements of evolutionary theory into his own, he did so in a critical way, and was not interested in developing a grand theory of society as much as developing a perspective and a method that could be applied in diverse ways. The sociological method that Durkheim devised, thus, sought to be free of the metaphysical positivism of Comte and Spencer and differed greatly from Comte’s mere extension of the scientific method of the natural sciences to society.

Several of Durkheim’s teachers at the École normale supérieure would also have an important impact on his thinking. With Emile Boutroux, Durkheim read Comte and got the idea that sociology could have its own unique subject matter that was not reducible to any other field of study. Gabriel Monod and Numa Denis Fustel de Coulanges, both historians, introduced Durkheim to systematic empirical and comparative methods that could be applied to history and the social sciences. Charles Renouvier, a neo-Kantian philosopher, also had a large impact on Durkheim. Renouvier was an adamant rationalist and likely played a fundamental role in shaping Durkheim’s interpretation of Kant, specifically Durkheim’s understanding of the categories, an understanding that some observers have called into question. Renouvier was also preoccupied with a number of ideas that would appear in Durkheim’s thinking, including the scientific study of morality or social cohesion and the relation of the individual to society.

Between 1885 and 1886, Durkheim spent an academic year visiting universities in Germany. What Durkheim found there impressed him deeply. He encountered German scholars such as Adolf Wagner, Gustav Schmoller, Rudolph von Jhering, Albert Schäffle, and Wilhelm Wundt who were working on scientific approaches to the study of ethics. Importantly these scholars were relating morality to other social institutions such as economics or the law, and in the process were emphasizing the social nature of morality. Arguably the most important of these thinkers for Durkheim was Wundt, who rejected methodological individualism and argued that morality was a sui generis social phenomenon that could not be reduced to individuals acting in isolation. Taken together, these thinkers laid the foundations for Durkheim’s social realism and provided a powerful critique to utilitarian conceptions of morality, epitomized by Spencer, which viewed the origin of morality within the rational, self-interested calculations of the individual.

Throughout Durkheim’s life, other notable thinkers would have a prominent impact on him. Early in his career Durkheim wrote dissertations about Jean-Jacques Rousseau and Montesquieu, both of whom he cited as precursors to sociology. John Stuart Mill’s writings on logic influenced Durkheim’s reflections on the sociological method. In 1895 Durkheim’s thinking about society changed dramatically after he read William Robertson Smith’s Lectures on the Religion of the Semites. It is generally recognized that around this period in Durkheim’s life he changed the themes and approaches in his work. Before this time, as in Division, Durkheim focused on how the material and morphological elements of a society affected it, whereas afterwards he began to concentrate on the ideational elements of society, with an increasing focus on représentations collectives, morality, religion, and social norms and values. Other philosophers are also prominent in Durkheim’s discussions. The most important of these, arguably, is Immanuel Kant, whose moral and epistemological theories were of great influence. However Plato, William James, and René Descartes, among others, are all present in Durkheim’s work and influenced him in substantial ways.

c. Reception of Durkheim’s Thought

Durkheim remains a fundamental and prominent figure for sociology and social theory in general. Yet, in comparison with Marx and Weber, the influence of Durkheim’s thought has been somewhat muted, especially with regards to philosophy. This can be partly explained by the fact that the Durkheimian school of thought was greatly reduced when many of his most promising students were killed in WWI, that Durkheim went to such great lengths to divorce sociology from philosophy, or by the fact that his thought has been, and continues to be, simplified, misunderstood, or ignored.

Nevertheless, his ideas had, and continue to have, a strong impact in the social sciences, especially in sociology and anthropology. Members of his research group, such as Marcel Mauss, Maurice Halbwachs, Robert Herz, Paul Fauconnet, Célestin Bouglé, and Lucien Lévy-Bruhl, and later thinkers, such as Talcott Parsons, Alfred Radcliffe-Brown, Robert Nisbet, and Claude Levi-Strauss, were all strongly influenced by him. Philosophers such as Henri Bergeson and Emmanuel Levinas acknowledge the influence of Durkheim’s ideas, and his work is present in the linguistic theories of Ferdinand de Saussure. In addition, Durkheim’s ideas are latent in the structuralist thought that emerged in post WWII France, for example in Alain Badiou, Louis Althusser, and Michel Foucault, as well as in the work of other post-war thinkers such as Jacques Lacan and Maurice Merleau-Ponty. His thought is also a precursor to many later developments in philosophy, including John Rawls’ concept of political liberalism and John Searle’s discussion of social institutions. These thinkers, however, never discuss Durkheim at length, or acknowledge any intellectual debt to him.

More recently, social theorists such as Pierre Bourdieu, Robert Bellah, and Steven Lukes, philosophers such as Charles Taylor and Hans Joas, and psychologists such as Jonathan Haidt have been influenced by Durkheim’s thinking. Notably Randall Collins has developed Durkheim’s analysis of ritual into a microsociology and a theory of conflict while Jeffrey Alexander and Philip Smith have formulated a research program in cultural sociology called the Strong Program that is influenced by Durkheim’s late works. Also, Durkheim’s concept of sui generis is analogous to the concept of emergence that arose in the philosophy of mind and the philosophy of social science in the 1960s. Authors working in these fields have begun recognizing Durkheim’s relevance to these discussions.

2. The Sociological Method: Society and the Study of Social Facts

According to Durkheim, all elements of society, including morality and religion, are part of the natural world and can be studied scientifically. In particular, Durkheim sees his sociology as the science of institutions, which refer to collective ways of thinking, feeling, and acting. A fundamental element of this science is the sociological method, which Durkheim formulated specifically for this purpose.

The foundational claim for Durkheim’s sociology, and what is to make up the subject matter for sociology, is the existence of what Durkheim calls social facts. A social fact, as defined in Rules, is “a category of facts which present very special characteristics: they consist of manners of acting, thinking, and feeling external to the individual, which are invested with a coercive power by virtue of which they exercise control over him” (Durkheim; 1982: 52). According to Durkheim, social facts have an objective reality that sociologists can study in a way similar to how other scientists, such as physicists, study the physical world. An important corollary to the above definition is that social facts are also internal to individuals, and it is only through individuals that social facts are able to exist. In this sense, externality means interior to individuals other than the individual subject. This leads to the seemingly paradoxical statement that social facts are both external and internal to the individual, a claim that has frequently been misunderstood and left Durkheim’s work open to criticism.

In order to fully grasp how social facts are created and operate, it must be understood that for Durkheim, a society is not merely a group of individuals living in one particular geographical location. Rather, a society is an ensemble of ideas, beliefs, and sentiments of all sorts that are realized through individuals; it indicates a reality that is produced when individuals interact with one another, resulting in the fusion of individual consciences. This fusion of individual consciences is a sui generis reality. This means that the social fact, much as water is the product of the combination of hydrogen and oxygen atoms, is a wholly new entity with distinct properties, irreducible to its composing parts, and unable to be understood by any means other than those proper to it. In other words, society is greater than the sum of its parts; it supercedes in complexity, depth, and richness, the existence of any one particular individual. This psychic reality is sometimes (although especially in Division) referred to by Durkheim with the term conscience collective, which can alternately be translated into English as collective conscience or collective consciousness. What is more, society and social phenomena can only be explained in sociological terms, as the fusion of individual consciences that, once created, follows its own laws. Society cannot be explained, for example, in biological or psychological terms. Social facts are key, since they are what constitute and express the psychic reality that is society. Through them individuals acquire particular traits, such as a language, a monetary system, values, religious beliefs, tendencies for suicide, or technologies, that they would never have had living in total isolation.

Durkheim identifies different kinds of social facts with constraint remaining a key feature of each. For example, social facts include a society’s legal code, religious beliefs, concept of beauty, monetary system, ways of dressing, or its language. In these cases it is easy to see how society imposes itself onto the individual from the outside through the establishment of social norms and values to which conformity is either expected or encouraged. Currents of opinion, or social phenomena that express themselves through individual cases, are also social facts. Examples include rates of marriage, birth, or suicide. In these cases, the operation of society on the individual is not so obvious. Nevertheless, these phenomena can be studied with the use of statistics, which accumulate individual cases into an aggregate and express a certain state of the collective mind. There are also social facts of a morphological, or structural, order, including the demographic and material conditions of life such as the number, nature, and relation of the composing parts of a society, their geographical distribution, their means of communication and so forth. While perhaps not as evident, these types of social facts are also influenced by collective ways of thinking, acting, or feeling and have the same characteristics of externality and constraint as the other types.

Durkheim thus identifies a broad range of social facts that correspond roughly with his intellectual development: in his early work he focuses on social morphology, he then wrote a book on suicide, while his late work concentrates on social norms and values seen especially in morality and religion. As Durkheim’s interests shifted, his notion of coercion also changed, as did his use of the word ‘constraint’. In his early work constraint has more of a repressive or obligatory nature, whereas in his later works he highlights the attracting or devotional aspects of social facts, or how individuals are drawn voluntarily to particular symbols, norms, or beliefs. In the latter case society still ‘constrains’ the thoughts and behavior of the individual, but in a radically different way. Important to point out also is that social facts operate at varying degrees of formality and complexity. Thus, while Durkheim’s language at times points to a homogenous or monolithic understanding of society, the social processes he describes should be understood as taking place with differing degrees of formality and complexity on many different levels of social interaction, and the method he provides can and should be used to study this diversity of social phenomena.

Durkheim provides a set of rules for studying social facts. While he lists a number of rules, the most fundamental come from Chapter 2 of Rules. The first and most important rule is to treat social facts as things. What Durkheim means by this is that social facts have an existence independent of the knowing subject and that they impose themselves on the observer. Social facts can be recognized by the sign that they resist the action of individual will upon them; as products of the collectivity, changing social facts require laborious effort. The next rule for studying social facts is that the sociologist must clearly delimit and define the group of phenomena being researched. This structures the research and provides the object of study a condition of verifiability. The sociologist must also strive to be as objective towards the facts they are working on as possible and remove any subjective bias or attachment to what they are investigating. Similarly, the sociologist must systematically discard any and all preconceptions and closely examine the facts before saying anything about them.

Durkheim applies these rules to empirical evidence he draws primarily from statistics, ethnography, and history. Durkheim treats this data in a rational way, which is to say that he applies the law of causality to it. At this, Durkheim introduces an important rationalist component to his sociological method, namely the idea that by using his rules human behavior can be explained through observable cause and effect relationships. Accordingly, he often uses a comparative-historical approach, which he sees as the core of the sociological method, to eliminate extraneous causes and find commonalities between different societies and their social facts. In so doing, he strives to find general laws that are universally applicable. Durkheim also argues that social facts can only be understood in relation to other social facts. As an example, he explains suicide rates not in reference to psychological factors, but rather to different social institutions and the way they integrate and regulate individuals within a group. In his work Durkheim also follows the historical development of political, educational, religious, economic, and moral institutions, particularly those of Western society, and makes a strict difference between historical analysis and sociology: whereas the historical method strives only to describe what happened in the past, sociology strives to explain the past. In other words, sociology searches for the causes and functions of social facts as they change over time.

a. Durkheim’s Social Realism

An important, and often misunderstood, element of Durkheim’s sociological method is to be found in what can be termed Durkheim’s social realism, or the idea that society is an objectively real entity that exists independently and autonomously of any particular individual, a view that is epitomized by his prescription to treat social facts as things. Within this realist position there are two important claims. First, Durkheim makes an ontological claim concerning the sui generis reality of social facts. Second, Durkheim makes an epistemological and methodological claim, arguing that social facts should be treated as real objects, existing external to the researcher’s mind, that can be determined by their ability to coerce behavior. Hence, Durkheim is arguing that social facts have particular properties of being and that they can be discovered and analyzed when the sociologist treats them in the proper, scientific way.

These elements of Durkheim’s sociology have led to some confusion. Some critics claim that Durkheim is guilty of saying that social facts exist independent and outside of all individuals, which leads them to think that Durkheim hypostatizes some sort of metaphysical “group mind.” Other critics argue that Durkheim is guilty of an ontologism or a realism in which he considers social facts to be material properties of social life.

Durkheim strongly refutes such accusations. In response to the first critique, it must be remembered that social facts are both exterior and interior to individuals, with externality in this case meaning interior to individuals other than the individual subject. As Durkheim argues, social facts exist in a special substratum of the individual mind. His position then ultimately is that while the social fact is unmistakably a sui generis product of social interaction, it is produced and resides exclusively in this special substratum of the individual mind. To say that social facts exist independent of all individuals is an absurd position that Durkheim does not advocate. Only on a methodological level, in order to study social facts from the outside as they present themselves to individuals, does the sociologist abstract social facts from the individual consciences in which they are present. In response to the second critique, Durkheim maintains that social facts, as products of the psyche, are wholly ideational and do not have a material substratum. They can only be observed through the more or less systematized phenomenal reality (to be analyzed as empirical data) that expresses them. By stating the reality of the ideational realm of social facts in this way, treating them as observable things of the natural world while maintaining they are ideal, Durkheim’s social realism can be seen as an attempt to bridge diverging schools of philosophical thought, such as realism and nominalism, or empiricism and idealism.

3. Durkheim’s Sociology of Knowledge

Durkheim was one of the first thinkers in the Western tradition to examine how an individual’s social milieu affects the way that individual perceives the world. His most definitive statement on the subject can be found in Forms, a book dedicated not only to studying religion, but also to understanding how logical thought arises out of society. Other works, such as Pragmatism and Sociology, a posthumous lecture series given late in his life, elaborate his views. His sociology of knowledge argues that many, if not all, facets of an individual’s thought and conception of the world are influenced by society. Not only are our common beliefs, ideas, and language determined by our social milieu, but even the concepts and categories necessary for logical thought, such as time, space, causality, and number, have their source in society. This logical structure helps to order and interpret the world, ensuring that individuals have a more or less homogenous understanding of the world and how it operates, without which human society would not be possible. To begin to understand Durkheim’s analysis, a fundamental concept of his sociology of knowledge, représentations collectives, needs to be discussed.

a. Représentations Collectives

According to Durkheim, no knowledge of the world is possible without humanity in some way representing it. Furthermore, Durkheim rejects the idea of the Ding an sich, or the transcendent thing in itself. This means that the world exists only as far as it is represented, and that all knowledge of the world necessarily refers back to how it is represented. Accordingly, the central part of Durkheim’s theory of knowledge is his concept of représentations collectives (this term could be translated into English as collective representations, although there is no English equivalent to Durkheim’s use of the French term représentation, which in his work can mean both a mental representation or copy of something or an idea about something). Représentations collectives are the body of representations a society uses to represent to itself things in reality, as those things relate to and affect society. It is important to note that while représentations collectives refer to things in reality, they are not simple images that reflect reality as it is projected onto the intellect from the outside. Rather they are the result of an interaction between the external world and society; in being represented by society, things are infused with elements of a society’s collective experience, providing those things with a meaning and value. Représentations collectives are thus the repositories and transmitters of collective experience and thereby embody and express the reality of a society’s collective existence. Représentations collectives can take many forms, including group symbols, language, and conceptual thought. Considering the central importance of représentations collectives to collective life, it is no surprise that Durkheim dedicated so much time to their study later in his career.

b. Durkheim’s Philosophy of Language

Durkheim’s analysis of language in many ways illustrates not only what he means by the term représentations collectives, but also how he sees society operating on a fundamental level. As Durkheim explains, words, or concepts, are unlike individual sensory representations, which are in a perpetual flux and unable to provide a stable and consistent form to thought. Concepts are impersonal, stand outside of time and becoming (le devenir), and the thought they engender is fixed and resists change. Consequently, language is also the realm through which the idea of truth is able to come into being, since through language individuals are able to conceive of a world of stable ideas that are common to different intelligences. Thus, language conforms to the two criteria for truth that Durkheim lays out, impersonality and stability. These two criteria are also precisely what allow for inter-subjective communication. Language is, therefore, obviously a sui generis product of social interaction; it is the product of the fusion of individual consciences, with the result being completely new and irreducible to the parts that make it up and with the result residing in the minds of individuals as a product of collective action. As such, language does not bear the imprint of any mind in particular, and is instead developed by society, that unique intelligence where all of the others come to meet and interact, contributing their ideas and sentiments to the social nexus. Words are merely the way in which society, in its totality, represents to itself objects of experience. In this way, language is also infused with the authority of society. With this, Durkheim makes a reference to Plato, saying that when confronted with this system of concepts, the individual mind is in the same situation as the nous of Plato before the world of ideas. The individual is thereby compelled to assimilate the concepts and appropriate them as their own, if only so as to be able to communicate with other individuals.

Language, as a set of représentations collectives, also has a unique quality in that it plays an active role in structuring an individual’s perception of reality. As Durkheim argues, objects of experience do not exist independently of the society that perceives and represents them. They exist only through the relationship they have with society, a relationship that can reveal very different aspects about reality depending on the society. This is because contained within language is all of the collective knowledge and experience that a group has accrued over the centuries and that informs a group’s beliefs and values. Through language society is able to pass on to an individual a body of collective knowledge that is infinitely rich and greatly exceeds the limits of individual experience. To think conceptually, thus, does not simply mean to see reality in a general way, or ‘as it is,’ it is to project a light onto reality, a light that penetrates, illuminates, and transforms reality. The way in which an individual, literally, sees the world, and the knowledge an individual comes to have about existence, therefore, is highly informed by the language that individual speaks.

c. The Categories

Language is not the only facet of logical thought that society engenders; society also plays a large role in creating the categories of thought, such as time, space, number, causality, personality and so forth. In formulating his theory, Durkheim is especially critical of rationalists, such as Kant, who believe that the categories of human thought are universal, independent of environmental factors, and located within the mind a priori. The categories, such as time and space, are not vague and indeterminate, as Kant suggests. Rather, they have a definite form and specific qualities (such as minutes, weeks, months for time, or north, south, inches, kilometers for space). The characteristics of the categories, furthermore, vary from culture to culture, sometimes greatly, leading Durkheim to believe that they are of a social origin. Durkheim’s rejection of the rationalists, however, does not lead him to the opposing theoretical framework, that of the empiricists. Durkheim is also critical of this school of thought, which argues that an individual’s experience of the world gives rise to the categories. Durkheim argues that the categories share the same properties as concepts. Categories, like concepts, have the qualities of stability and impersonality, both of which are necessary conditions for the mutual understanding of two minds. Like concepts, then, categories have a necessarily social function and are the product of social interaction. Individuals could therefore never create the categories on their own. Durkheim believes that it is possible to overcome the opposition between rationalism and empiricism by accounting for reason without ignoring the world of observable empirical data. In order to do so, Durkheim treats the categories as représentations collectives, and studies them as such.

As Durkheim argues, the categories are the natural, sui generis result of the co-existence and interaction of individuals within a social framework. As représentations collectives created by society, the categories exist independently of the individual and impose themselves onto the individual’s mind, which would have no capacity for categorical thought otherwise. What is more, not only does society institute the categories in this way, but different aspects of the social being serve as the content of the categories. For example, the rhythm of social life serves as the base for the category of time, the spatial arrangement of the group serves as a base for the category of space, the social grouping of society (for example in clans or phratries) serves as a base for the category of class (as in the classification of items), and collective force is at the origin of the concept of an efficacious force, which was essential to the very first formulations of the category of causality. Another category of utmost importance is the category of totality, the notion of everything, which originates from the concept of the social group in total. The categories are not, of course, used only to relate to society. Rather, they extend and apply to the entire universe, helping individuals to explain rationally the world around them. As a result, the ways in which individuals understand the world through the categories can vary in important ways.

This element of Durkheim’s theory has a significant flaw, however. As Steven Lukes has pointed out, Durkheim does not distinguish between the faculties of categorical thinking, such as the faculty of temporality, and the content of these faculties, such as dividing time into set units of measurement. Instead, Durkheim views both the capacity and the content of categorical thought as stamped onto the individual mind by society at the same time. As such, Durkheim’s theory fails to account for the inherent abilities of categorical or logical thought. There may be different classifications within a society, for example, but in order for an individual to recognize these classifications in the first place, they must have prior possession of the ability to recognize classifications. Despite this flaw, an important element of Durkheim’s theory, the idea that the content of the categories is modeled on the organization of society and social life, has proven to be challenging and influential to later thinkers.

d. The Classification of Knowledge

Another vital role that society plays in the construction of human knowledge is the fact that it actively organizes objects of experience into a coherent classificatory system that encompasses the entire universe. With these classificatory systems it becomes possible to attach things one to another and to establish relations between them. This allows us to see things as functions of each other, as if they were following an interior law that was founded in their nature and provides order to an otherwise chaotic world. What is more, Durkheim argues that it was through religion that the very first cosmologies, or classificatory systems of the universe, came into being, in the form of religious myth. Religion was thus the first place where humans could attempt to rationally explain and understand the world around them. As a result, Durkheim argues that the evolution of logic is strongly linked to the evolution of religion (though both ultimately depend upon social conditions). This leads to the claim that religion is at the origin of much, if not all, of human knowledge. This argument has a far reach, affecting even the way in which modern science views itself. Following Durkheim, while modern science might claim to have no kinship with religion and in fact claim to be opposed to religion, it is in effect through religion that the conceptual and logical thought necessary for scientific thinking originated and was first elaborated. This component of Durkheim’s sociology of knowledge has been highly provocative and influential both in sociology and beyond.

e. Cultural Relativism versus Scientific Truth

With such a theory of knowledge, Durkheim reveals himself to be a cultural relativist, arguing that each culture has a network of self-referential logic and concepts that creates truths that are legitimate and, while not necessarily grounded in the reality of the physical world, are grounded within the reality of their respective social framework. Truths of this nature Durkheim calls mythological truths. In opposition to this relativistic view of truth, however, Durkheim also defends scientific rationalism and the idea that there exist scientific truths that are not dependent on cultural context and that express reality “as it is.” These scientific truths, or scientific représentations, are subjected to stringent verification and methodological control, and while they express these truths through inadequate symbols and in an approximated way, they are more perfect and more reliable than other représentations collectives. Despite the fact that they are of a fundamentally different nature (expressing reality as it is and not the reality of society), scientific représentations operate in the same way and are just as instrumental to society as other représentations collectives. Scientific truths deal with the same subject matter as mythological truths (nature, man, society), and like other représentations collectives they serve to reinforce and unify the collective conscience around one idea. Scientific truths are also représentations to which society has added the knowledge it has accumulated historically through collaborative effort. Scientific représentations reflect collective experience and express the relationship a society has with the world around it. Thus, while, there are objective truths about the world to be discovered, it would be mistaken to think that reality exists independently, or is logically antecedent, of it being represented through society, since it is only through collective effort that these scientific truths are discovered, and thus come to being. Scientific truths, while of a special nature, are also in an important way bound by the limits of society.

Yet one might wonder how Durkheim can claim that both sets of truths are true or in some way reflect reality. As W.S.F. Pickering has noted, this issue is resolved when one understands that Durkheim is a multi-realist, meaning reality is complex and operates on multiple levels. Hence Durkheim is able to maintain that mythological truths are true to the extent that a group holds them to be true, while also claiming that scientific truths reflect the true nature of reality.

f. Conclusion

In the end, Durkheim strives to account for a total sociology of knowledge. Society creates for itself, through its représentations collectives, a vast network of language and logical thought that is instrumental in allowing its individuals to understand and think the world. And, since the world exists only as far as it is thought, and since the world is totally thought only by society, the world takes its shape in society. In other words, society establishes, from the outset, the limits of possibility for rationality, linguistic expression, and knowledge in general.

4. Durkheim’s Philosophy of Religion

During Durkheim’s life, his thinking about religion changed in important ways. Early in his life, as in Division, he argued that human societies could exist on a secular basis without religion. But as time went on he saw religion as a more and more fundamental element of social life. By the time he wrote Forms, Durkheim saw religion as a part of the human condition, and while the content of religion might be different from society to society over time, religion will, in some form or another, always be a part of social life. Durkheim also argues that religion is the most fundamental social institution, with almost all other social institutions, at some point in human history, being born from it. For these reasons he gave special analysis to this phenomenon, providing a philosophy of religion that is perhaps as provocative as it is rich with insights.

According to Durkheim, religion is the product of human activity, not divine intervention. He thus treats religion as a sui generis social fact and analyzes it sociologically. Durkheim elaborates his theory of religion at length in his most important work, Forms. In this book Durkheim, uses the ethnographic data that was available at the time to focus his analysis on the most primitive religion that, at the time, was known, the totemic religion of Australian aborigines. This was done for methodological purposes, since Durkheim wished to study the simplest form of religion possible, in which the essential elements of religious life would be easier to ascertain. In a certain sense, then, Durkheim is investigating the old question, albeit in a new way, of the origin of religion. It is important to note, however, that Durkheim is not searching for an absolute origin, or the radical instant where religion first came into being. Such an investigation would be impossible and prone to speculation. In this metaphysical sense of origin, religion, like every social institution, begins nowhere. Rather, as Durkheim says, he is investigating the social forces and causes that are always already present in a social milieu and that lead to the emergence of religious life and thought at different points in time, under different conditions.

Durkheim’s analysis is not without its detractors, who criticize among other things his methodology, his interpretation of ethnographic data, or his undermining of traditional religion. Nevertheless, his assertion that religion has an essentially social foundation, as well as other elements of his theory, have been reaffirmed and re-appropriated over the years by a number of different thinkers.

It is important to look at the starting point of Durkheim’s analysis, his definition of religion: “A religion is a unified system of beliefs and practices relative to sacred things, that is to say, things set apart and forbidden–beliefs and practices which unite in one single moral community called a Church, all those who adhere to them” (Durkheim; 1995: 44). There are, thus, three fundamental elements to every religion: sacred objects, a set of beliefs and practices, and the existence of a moral community. Of the three, perhaps the most important would be the notion of the sacred, which is the point around which any religious system revolves. It is that which inspires great respect and admiration on the part of society and what is set apart and keeps believers at a distance. Durkheim contrasts the sacred with the notion of profane, or that which desecrates the sacred and from which the sacred must be protected, making the opposition between sacred and profane a central element of Durkheim’s theory. With this definition Durkheim also puts an emphasis on the social element of religion. This is important because he spends a great deal of time in Forms arguing against theorists like Herbert Spencer, Edward Tylor, or James Frazer who locate the origin of religion in psychological phenomena such as dreams (the animistic view of Spencer) or natural phenomena, such as storms (the naturalistic view of the latter two). Durkheim argues that such an interpretation of phenomena is socially learned, and could only be the effect of an already established religion, not its cause. With this said, it is now time to examine how Durkheim believes a religion originates and operates.

According to Durkheim, a religion comes into being and is legitimated through moments of what he calls “collective effervescence.” Collective effervescence refers to moments in societal life when the group of individuals that makes up a society comes together in order to perform a religious ritual. During these moments, the group comes together and communicates in the same thought and participates in the same action, which serves to unify a group of individuals. When individuals come into close contact with one another and when they are assembled in such a fashion, a certain “electricity” is created and released, leading participants to a high degree of collective emotional excitement or delirium. This impersonal, extra-individual force, which is a core element of religion, transports the individuals into a new, ideal realm, lifts them up outside of themselves, and makes them feel as if they are in contact with an extraordinary energy.

The next step in the genesis of religion is the projecting of this collective energy onto an external symbol. As Durkheim argues, society can only become conscious of these forces circulating in the social world by representing them somehow. The power of religion must therefore be objectified, or somehow made visible, and the object onto which this force is projected becomes sacred. This sacred object receives the collective force and is thereby infused with the power of the community. It is in this way that a society gains a tangible idea, or representation, of itself. When discussing these matters, Durkheim is careful to use the word “sacred object” to describe what is traditionally understood in the West as a god. This is because sacred objects can be very diverse and do not necessarily refer to supernatural deities. For example, God is a sacred object for Christian societies, Thor was a sacred object for Viking society, but the four noble truths are also sacred objects for Buddhists, and, as we will see, the individual person has become a sacred object for modern, Western society. Physical objects, such as rocks, feathers, totem polls, crosses, and so forth, can also become infused with the force of the collectivity, thereby becoming sacred and serving as a physical reminder of society’s presence. Such views on religion allow Durkheim to make the radical claim that a society’s sacred object is nothing but the collective forces of the group transfigured. Religion is society worshipping itself, and through religion, individuals represent to themselves society and their relationship to it.

With this, Durkheim lays bare the inner workings of a society’s symbolic network. With Durkheim’s rejection of the thing in itself, the meaning and value of an object are not intrinsic to it, but are to be found in that object’s relationship to society. Said otherwise, an object’s status is determined by the meaning that society attributes to it, or by its status as a représentation collective. Importantly, this analysis goes beyond what is strictly considered the religious realm, since all socially derived meaning operates in the same way. For example, a stamp, a flag, or the sport of football are by themselves just a piece of paper, a piece of cloth, or a group of padded men chasing a leather ball; they all have no value in themselves and derive their value from the sui generis collective forces they represent and embody. The more important a society determines an object to be, the more a group infuses an object with prestige, the more valuable it will be in the eyes of an individual.

If these moments of collective effervescence are the origin of religious feelings, religious rituals must be repeated in order to reaffirm the collective unity of a society, otherwise its existence is at risk. Durkheim remarks that if the societal forces central to the religious life of a society are not re-animated, they will be forgotten, leaving individuals with no knowledge of the ties that exist between them and no concept of the society to which they belong. This is why religious ritual is necessary for the continued existence of a society; religion cannot exist through belief alone-it periodically needs the reality of the force behind the belief to be regenerated. This takes place through various religious rituals, in which collective beliefs are reaffirmed and the individual expresses their solidarity with the sacred object of society, or with society itself. The form the specific ritual takes can vary greatly, from funerals to rain dances to patriotic national holidays, but its goal is always the same. Through these rituals, society maintains its existence and integrates individuals into the social fold, exerting pressure on them to act and think alike. While Durkheim’s analysis is of explicitly religious contexts, it is important to note that the ritual interaction processes he describes take place in different and less formal contexts as well. Ritual processes can be considered a part of daily life and are instrumental in regulating group solidarities and interpersonal relationships in different social institutions and at different levels of formality.

Of great significance to Durkheim’s theory is his insistence on the reality of these religious phenomena. As he argues, the social forces that animate a society’s religious life are real, and are really felt by the participants. While it is a mistake for an individual to believe that this power emanates directly from the sacred object, or is somehow intrinsic to the sacred object, behind the symbol manifesting the force is a living and concrete reality. Consequently, all religions are true, at least symbolically, for they express a power that does exist, the power of society. Religion, religious belief, and the religious experience cannot, therefore, be dismissed as mere fantasies or illusions.

5. Durkheim on Morality

Durkheim’s moral philosophy was unfortunately denied its culmination by his untimely death in 1917. His writings on the subject, therefore, lack the consistency he would have liked to give them. Nevertheless, he did publish several important articles, most notably The Determination of Moral Facts (1906), and gave lectures on the subject, including the posthumously published Moral Education, from which his views on morality can be deciphered.

Durkheim’s moral theory is unique in that he rejects theorists who rely on a priori moral concepts or abstract logical reasoning to construct ethical systems. Rather, Durkheim treats moral phenomena as conditioned both socially and historically. Each society creates over time its own set of moral rules and truths, which can vary dramatically from one society to the next, with each society creating for itself moral principles that are more or less adequate to its existential needs. When analyzing moral phenomena, the moral philosopher must take into consideration the socio-historical context of the moral system they are operating in and make moral prescriptions accordingly, or risk doing great harm to that society. However, that there exists no universal or transcendent morality for humanity in no way abnegates the validity of any moral system and does not open the door to moral nihilism. On the contrary, moral rules are rooted in the sui generis reality of society that the individual cannot deny; morality is a social fact and should be studied as such. This approach to morality would form the basis of what Durkheim considers a physique des moeurs, or a physics of morality, a new, empirical, rational science of morality. Yet, what exactly does Durkheim understand morality to be? And how does it operate in a society?

While Durkheim’s understanding of morality can at times be vague and lead to several interpretations, he most often understands morality as a system of rules and maxims that prescribes to individuals’ ways of behaving in different situations. Contained within this moral system is a set of moral values, beliefs, and truths that provide a framework for the rules. Morality is also a wholly social phenomenon, with morality not existing outside of the limits of society. As Durkheim claims, morality begins only when an individual pertains to a group.

Moral rules have several unique characteristics that separate them from other rules that might be found in society. These special features lie in morality’s obligatory nature and in its desirability. According to Durkheim, at the heart of morality is a central moral authority that commands to its adherents its moral precepts. Through this central authority the individual feels an external constraint to conform to a society’s moral code. Obligation is thus a fundamental element of morality. This aspect of morality corresponds closely to the Kantian notion of duty, whose influence Durkheim openly acknowledges. However, Durkheim was critical of the Kantian notion of duty, since he felt that the repressive notion of duty was lacking a positive counterweight. For Durkheim, such a counterweight is found in the desirability of morality, which is equally important and necessary for the existence of morality. What Durkheim means with the desirability of morality is that the individual views the authority dictating to them their obligations as a higher power that is worthy of their respect and devotion. When an individual performs their duty, they feel as if they are working towards some sort of higher end, which Durkheim equates to the good (le bien). As a result, the individual willingly accepts the obligatory nature of moral rules and views them beneficially.

Within this dual movement of obligation-desire, Durkheim views to a large extent the influence of religion. According to Durkheim morality and religion are intimately linked, and goes so far as to say that the moral life and the religion of a society are intimately intertwined. Wherever one finds a religion, one will find with it an accompanying moral doctrine and moral ideals that are commanded to believers. Moral authority is, thus, born out of religious life and draws its authority from the power of religion, which, as seen in the section above, is merely society’s collective force transfigured and made visible. Religious imagery therefore takes on a moral tone and can be an important physical source of moral authority in a society. It is not surprising to Durkheim then that religious imagery inspires the same emotions of fear, obedience, and respect that an individual feels in the face of moral imperatives. In this way, moral authority is constituted by a force that is greater than the individual, outside of the individual, but also a force that penetrates the individual and shapes their personality.

Importantly, this aspect of Durkheim’s work establishes a theory of legitimate authority that is very different from Max Weber’s famous tripartite classification of legal-rational, traditional, and charismatic authority. Whereas a common critique of Weber is that his theory is overly operational and fails to account for the normative dimension of authority, the legitimation of authority for Durkheim is moral, meaning it is explicitly tied to a set of values and a notion of good and bad. This point is important also because a key part of morality according to Durkheim is the notion of sanction. Society sanctions individuals according to the moral rules and norms it establishes. Sanctions have a disciplinary effect and can be both positive, as in a reward for good behavior, and negative, as in sending a criminal to prison for breaking the law. Because moral rules are tied to a legitimate authority, individuals consider both the rules and the sanctions legitimate.

Yet, one is inclined to ask, is the individual free to critique moral rules? Can morality not be changed? Is there any space for individual autonomy in this matter? According to Durkheim, moral rules do not need to be blindly followed by individuals. If the individual finds reason to object, critique, or rebel against the moral principles of society, not only is this possible, but it is perhaps even beneficial to society. For example, it is possible that changes take place within a society that can either cause a moral principle to be forgotten, or produce a schism between a traditional moral system and new moral sentiments that have not yet been recognized by the collective conscience. When this happens, an individual is correct to show the relevance of the forgotten moral principle or to illuminate what these new moral sentiments are exactly (as an example of the latter case Durkheim points to Socrates). For these purposes, the physique des moeurs can be very helpful. Thus, an individual is able to experiment with different moral claims, but only granted that these moral claims reflect that actual moral state, or states, of society (the individual is of course free to completely reject society, but this would only confirm the existence of the moral rules being rejected and potentially cause harm to the individual). This last caveat demonstrates that even when the individual acts in an autonomous way, they are, morally speaking, still bound by the limits of society.

Finally, it is also worth mentioning here that although Durkheim does not discuss the issue at length, his analysis of morality lends itself to a theory of conflict in which competing groups maintain different concepts of good and allegiance to different moral authorities. Different authors working in the Durkheimian tradition have developed his work in precisely this direction.

6. Social Change and Modernity in the West

One of the most prominent and problematic interpretations of Durkheim’s thought is the misconception that he does not have a theory of social change. On the contrary, social change is one of Durkheim’s primary focuses. Indeed, throughout his work he explores Europe’s difficult transition from a medieval society to a modern one. Thus, Durkheim’s structural analyses of social institutions are complemented in important ways by analyses of the dynamic nature of these phenomena.

a. Causes of Social Change

Durkheim elaborates much of his theory of social change in Division, although he does return to the topic in other works such as Rules. Essentially Durkheim argues that social change is spurred above all by changes in the ways that people interact with each other, which in turn depend upon the demographic and material conditions of a society. The two main factors affecting social interaction are increases in population density and advances in technology, most notably in the fields of communication and transportation. This is because population growth and advances in technology increase social connectivity, leading to interactions that differ in quantity, intimacy, frequency, type, and content. Cities, the locus of social change, also emerge and grow as a result of changes in population and technology. The rate at which individuals come into contact and interact with one another in a meaningful way is what Durkheim calls moral or dynamic density.

The most important change to take place as a result of increased moral density occurs on a structural level and is what Durkheim calls the division of labor. At their beginning, societies are characterized by what Durkheim calls mechanical solidarity. In mechanical solidarity, groups are small, individuals in the group resemble each other, and their individual conscience is more or less synonymous with and dependent on the collective conscience. Individuals belong to the group and the individual and individuality as we understand them do not exist. As the moral density increases, this changes. Appealing to Darwin’s evolutionary theory that the more alike two organisms are the greater the combat for the resources will be, Durkheim argues that with an increase in moral density comes greater competition for fewer resources. In order to mitigate the competition and make social life harmonious, individuals in a society will specialize their tasks and pursue different means to make a living. The more a society grows in moral density, the more the labor of a society will divide and the more specialized the tasks of its individuals will become. This leads to what Durkheim calls organic solidarity, or solidarity based not upon individual resemblances, but upon the functional interdependence of society’s individual parts, much the way the organs of a body are interdependent.

It should be noted that the terms mechanical and organic solidarity are features of Durkheim’s early work only, and soon after the publication of Division he abandoned them. In his later work he continues examining how societies change as a result of an increase in dynamic density, yet he understands solidarity in more symbolic and religious terms, with periods of great ritual and collective effervescence, such as the Renaissance, the Reformation, or the French Revolution, playing an integral role in social change. Concerning the specific impacts of the increase of dynamic density and the division of labor in society, Durkheim concentrates his analysis on Europe.

b. The Division of Labor and the Emergence of Modernity in Europe

The industrialization and urbanization of Western Europe had great effects on society in a number of different ways. One of the most important effects was the rise of individualism and the importance of the individual within Western society, which took place on different levels. With the division of labor, there was a specialization of tasks, which gave the individual more freedom to develop their work. As a result, individual autonomy increased, since the rest of society was less and less capable of telling the individual how to do the work. At the same time city life was characterized by fewer and weaker intimate relationships and greater anonymity, which granted greater personal freedoms. As a result, the individual felt in a real way less acted upon by society and there were fewer and fewer collective experiences shared by all members of the group. These changes in society had the effect of individuating the population and creating differences between individuals. Christian moral doctrine, which places emphasis on individual spirituality, also had a role in shaping these changes and influencing Western individualism. The creation of the individual in these ways is perhaps the defining characteristic of modernity.

It is worth noting here Durkheim’s opposition to social contract theorists and utilitarians, like Spencer, who argue that society begins when individuals come together to form groups. In many ways his book Division is a refutation of this theory and strives to show that collective life is not born from the individual, but, rather, that the individual is born out of collective life.

The increase in dynamic density and the division of labor also had major impacts on economic, social, and political institutions. In medieval society, there were well-defined social institutions in the realms of religion, politics, and education that were each distinct from one another. The organization of the economic sector was especially important, with guilds developing into strong, independent institutions that were at the heart of social life. These institutions regulated prices and production and maintained good relations between members of the same craft. These institutions and structures of society ensured that individuals were integrated into the social fold properly, promoting social solidarity. In the 18th and 19th centuries, however, a large growth in population was coupled with a large demographic shift, which was aided by technological innovation (such as the railroad, the steamship, and various manufacturing techniques). Without the previous restrictions on mobility or production capabilities, cities grew greatly in size, production of goods centralized, and the economic and social equilibrium that existed in the medieval period was ruptured. The ever-greater mobility of goods and people extended the reach of economic, political, and social institutions. As a result the guild system disappeared and regional trading interdependence gave way to international interdependence. Large-scale institutions in politics, education, shipping, manufacturing, arts, banking and so forth that were free from regional limitations developed in cities and extended their influence to greater portions of society.

In essence, Durkheim is describing the birth of the modern industrial state. The concentration of the population and the centralization of the means of production created an enormous shift in the way of life for large parts of European society. It also changed the way that people related to one another. The way of life that corresponded to medieval society no longer corresponded to the way of life in the modern industrial world. It was impossible for new generations to live in the same ways as their predecessors and European society witnessed a weakening of all its previous traditions, particularly its religious traditions.

c. The Death of the Gods

In 1912, Durkheim wrote: “the former gods are growing old or dying, and others have not been born” (Durkheim; 1995: 429). This quote points to an incredibly important but often overlooked part of Durkheim’s work, namely his declaration of the death of the gods and what this means for the future of Western civilization. Durkheim’s declaration, however, should not be confused with Friedrich Nietzsche’s famous “death of God.” While Durkheim was familiar with some of Nietzsche’s work and favorable points of comparison between the two could be made on the subject, Durkheim does not appear to have been influenced by Nietzsche in this respect. Rather, Durkheim’s declaration of the death of the gods is closely linked to his analysis of the social disintegration of European society brought about by modernity, a subject that he comes back to throughout the entirety of his career, from Division to Forms. Yet how is one to understand this statement? What does this mean for European society?

There are two parts to Durkheim’s declaration that need to be de-compacted. On the one hand the old gods are dead. Because of the massive transformations taking place, European society became profoundly destructured. The institutions animating medieval life disappeared. As a result, individuals were having a hard time finding meaningful attachments to social groups and society as a whole lost its former unity and cohesiveness. Not only this, but the transformations that led to modernity also rendered former beliefs and practices irrelevant. The big things of the past, the political, economic, social, and especially religious institutions, no longer inspired the enthusiasm they once did. With former ways of life no longer relevant and society no longer cohesive, the collective force so vital for the life of a society was no longer generated. This would have an important impact on the religion of medieval society, Christianity. Because society no longer had the means to create the collective force that exists behind God, belief in God weakened substantially. Christian society was no longer sufficiently present to the individual for faith in God to be maintained; the individual no longer felt, literally, the presence of God in their lives. With the lack of faith in God also came a rejection of other elements of Christian doctrine, such as Christian morality and Christian metaphysics, which were beginning to be replaced respectively by modern notions of justice and modern science. In sum, the social milieu that supported Christianity disappeared, leaving Christian faith, values, and thinking without any social foundations to give them life.

That Christianity faded away in European society is not a problem in itself, for it merely reflects a natural course of development a society may take. The problem arises when taking into consideration the second element to Durkheim’s phrase: no new gods have been created to replace the old ones. For Durkheim, the changes in European society were taking place too quickly and no new institutions had been able to form in the absence of the old ones. European society had not yet been able to create a religion to replace Christianity. Instead what Durkheim saw in Europe was a society in a state of disaggregation characterized by a lack of cohesion, unity, and solidarity. Individuals in such a society have no bonds between them and interact in a way similar to molecules of water, without any central force that is able to organize them and give them shape. European society had become nothing but a pile of sand that the slightest wind would succeed at dispersing. In other words, European society was no longer a society in Durkheim’s sense of the word, and as such was open to a number of further problems.

To begin, such a society is incapable of generating social forces that act on the individual. It is unable to create an authority that exerts pressure on individuals to act and think in a similar manner. Without these forces acting on the individual from the outside, individuals are dispersed from their commitment to society and left to their own. Duties are no longer accepted carte blanche and moral rules no longer seem binding. As such, individuals increasingly are detached from group obligation and act out of self-interest. These are the two conditions that Durkheim believes characterize the moral situation of modern European society: rampant individualism and weak morality. Durkheim’s term for this “froid moral” in which morality breaks down is anomie, a state of deregulation, in which the traditional rules have lost their authority.

A second problem stemming from the fact that society is no longer present to individuals is a higher suicide rate, specifically with two types of suicide that Durkheim identifies in Suicide. The first is egoistic suicide, in which an individual no longer see a purpose to life and sees life as meaningless. These feelings arise because the bonds integrating the individual to society have weakened or been broken. This problem involves society because society is an important source of meaning and direction for individuals, giving them goals to pursue and norms to guide them. The second type of suicide is anomic suicide, which involves what Durkheim calls a “mal d’infini.” Normally society, with the help of its moral code, plays an important part in defining what are legitimate aspirations in life, as concerns wealth, material goods, or any other type of pleasure. Without limits set on these desires, the passions are unregulated, and the individual’s expectations do not correspond with reality. Consequently the individual is perpetually unhappy. Both types of suicide result from a weakness of social solidarity and an inability for society to adequately integrate its individuals.

A final consequence is that society has no central measure for truth and no authoritative way of organizing or understanding the world. In such a state, there arises the potential for conflict between individuals or groups who have different ways of understanding the world. Such a conflict could be seen in the 19^th and early 20^th centuries between Christian religious doctrine and modern science, a conflict that Durkheim’s own sociology took part in and one that continues today.

Essentially, Durkheim’s analysis of the death of the gods concentrates on the underlying disorganization of European society that led to the demise not only of Christianity, but of a number of other economic, political, and social institutions as well. This same underlying disorganization was preventing European society from generating the collective force necessary for the creation of new institutions and a new sacred object. The death of the gods is a symptom of a sickened society, one that has lost its internal structure and descended into an-archy, or a society with no authority and no definitive principles, moral or otherwise, to build itself on. In spite of such a glum analysis, Durkheim did have hope for the future. Out of the chaos he saw the emergence of a new religion that would guide the West, what he termed “the cult of the individual.”

d. The Cult of the Individual: Durkheim and Politics

According to the later Durkheim, religion is part of the human condition and as long as humans are grouped in collective life they will inevitably form a religion of some sort. Europe could thus be characterized as in a state of transition; out of the ashes of Christianity, a new religion would eventually emerge. This new religion would form around the sacred object of the human person as it is represented in the individual, the only element common to all in a society that is becoming more and more diverse and individualized. Appropriately, Durkheim calls this new religion the ‘cult of the individual.’ But how does this religion begin? What is its conception of individual? And what kind of society/religion does the cult of the individual create?

The cult of the individual begins, like all religions according to Durkheim, with collective effervescence, the first moments of which can be found in the democratic revolutions taking place in Europe and elsewhere at the end of the 18th and during the 19th centuries. Durkheim identifies the French Revolution as an example of such a release of collective energy. The concept of individual that these democratic revolutions were embracing follows strongly the line of thinking established during the Enlightenment; it is based on a general idea of human dignity and does not lead to a narcissistic, egotistical worship of the self. As Durkheim argues, the individualism of the cult of the individual is that of Kant and Rousseau; it is what the Déclaration des droits de l’homme et du citoyen (Declaration of the Rights of Man and of the Citizen), the document produced by revolutionaries during the French Revolution, attempted to codify more or less successfully. The cult of the individual thus presupposes an autonomous individual endowed with rationality, born both free and equal to all other individuals in these respects. Belief in this abstract conception of individual creates the ideal around which the cult revolves, and influences both the society’s morality and its notion of truth.

With this sacred object at its core, the cult of the individual also contains moral ideals to pursue. These moral ideals that define society include the ideals of equality, freedom, and justice. The specific moral code that translates these ideals is built around the inalienable rights of the individual; any disenfranchisement of an individual’s human rights or any violation of an individual’s human dignity is considered sacrilege and is a moral offence of the highest order. With society becoming more diverse, the respect, tolerance, and promotion of individual differences become important social virtues. It is by protecting the rights of the individual in this way, somewhat paradoxically, that society is best preserved. Modern democracy, which encodes, institutionalizes, and protects the rights of the individual, is the form of government whereby Western societies best express their collective belief in the dignity of the individual.

Rationality is also of primary importance to this religion. The cult of the individual has as a first dogma the autonomy of reason and as a first right free inquiry. Authority can and must be rationally grounded in order for the critically rational individual to have respect for social institutions. In line with the importance of rationality, modern science provides the cosmology for the cult of the individual. Scientific truths have come to be accepted by society as a whole and Durkheim even says that modern society has faith in science in a way similar to how past societies had faith in Christianity cosmology; despite that most individuals do not participate in or fully understand the scientific experiments taking place, the general population trusts scientific findings and accepts them as true. Modern science has an advantage, however, in that, unlike other religious cosmologies, it avoids dogmatizing about reality and permits individuals to challenge scientific theories through rational inquiry, fitting with the doctrine of the cult of the individual perfectly.

However, with the large growth in population and the individualization of society, it becomes very easy for society to lose hold of individuals or for the state to become out of touch with the population it serves. What is more, if society becomes too atomized the state risks becoming domineering. As a way of preventing the creation of a wholly individualistic society, Durkheim advocates the existence of intermediary groups, such as religious institutions, labor unions, families, regional groupings, and different types of other civil society groups. These groups would serve a double purpose. On the one hand they would be intimate enough to provide sufficient social bonds for the individual, which would serve to integrate the individual into the society and develop their moral conscience. On the other hand, they would represent the demands of individuals to the government and check state power, thereby ensuring that the state does not become domineering. At the same time, Durkheim understands that these secondary groups run the risk of dominating the individual and cutting them off from the wider society. In such a situation society would risk fragmenting into distinct groupings, leading to social conflict. Hence, Durkheim also recognizes the need for the state to exercise its authority over secondary groups as a way of liberating the individual and having them participate in the higher society and moral order that the state represents. Ultimately this dialectic between the state and the secondary group ensures the proper functioning of a democratic society, namely by ensuring that individuals are properly socialized and that neither the state nor the secondary groups become repressive towards the individual.

The way in which each country implements the cult of the individual ultimately depends on that country’s history and culture, indicating that different varieties of the cult of the individual are possible. Through this new religion of the cult of the individual, to which he gave his full support, Durkheim predicted that European society would once again find the unity and cohesion it was lacking; once again it would have a sacred object. The extent to which Durkheim’s predictions have come true can be debated, although several developments since his death point to the validity of his thought. For example, in 1948 the United Nations passed the Universal Declaration of Human Rights. This document could be regarded as one of the central holy texts of the cult of the individual, helping frame contemporary international moral discourse. What is more, Durkheim’s discussion of the cult of the individual pre-dates those that arose in the 1980s with regards to communitarianism and liberalism. In particular, there are strong parallels between the rationally grounded society Durkheim describes, which unites different secondary groups around individual democratic rights, values, and procedures, and John Rawls’ notion of political liberalism or Jürgen Habermas’ notion of constitutional patriotism. In these ways, Durkheim’s work makes important and enduring contributions to political theory and political sociology.

7. The Individual and Society

Durkheim is one of the first thinkers in the Western tradition, along with other 19^th century thinkers such as Friedrich Nietzsche, Charles Peirce, and Karl Marx, to reject the Cartesian model of the self, which stipulates a transcendental, purely rational ego existing wholly independent of outside influence. In opposition to the Cartesian model, Durkheim views the self as integrated in a web of social, and thus historical, relations that greatly influence their actions, interpretations of the world, and even their abilities for logical thought. What is more, social forces can be assimilated by the individual to the point where they operate on an automatic, instinctual level, in which the individual is unaware of the effect society has on their tastes, moral inclinations, or even their perception of reality. Social forces thus comprise an unconscious “substructure” of the mind, in which they have to varying degrees been incorporated by the individual. In consequence, if an individual wants to know themselves, they must understand the society of which they are a part, and how this society has a direct impact on their existence. In fact, in a complete reversal of Descartes, Durkheim, following the sociological method, advocates that in order to understand one’s self, the individual must avoid introspection and look outside of themselves, at the social forces that determine their personality. In these ways, Durkheim anticipated by at least fifty years the post-modern deconstruction of the self as a socio-historically determined entity.

Partly because of this conception of the individual, and partly because of his methodology and theoretical stances, Durkheim has been routinely criticized on several points. Critics argue that he is a deterministic thinker and that his view of society is so constraining towards the individual that it erases any possibility for individual autonomy and freedom. Others argue that his sociology is too holistic and that it leaves no place for the individual or for subjective interpretations of social phenomena. Critics have gone so far as to accuse Durkheim of being anti-individual due in part to his consistent claims that the individual is derived from society.

Such critics, however, misconstrue a number of elements of Durkheim’s thought. To begin, one should recall that social facts, while sui generis products of society, exist only as far as individuals incorporate them. On this point Durkheim makes clear on several occasions that individuals incorporate and appropriate elements of society, such as religious beliefs, morality, or language, in their own manner. While it is true that représentations collectives, for example, are the work of the collectivity and express collective thought through the individual, when the individual assimilates them they are refracted and colored by the individual’s personal experiences, thereby differentiating them. Thus, each individual expresses society in their own way. It should also be remembered that social facts are the result of a fusion of individual minds. As such there is a delicate interplay between the individual and society whereby the individual not only maintains their individuality, but is also able to enrich the field of social forces by contributing to it their own personal thoughts and feelings.

In another sense, critics claiming that Durkheim is anti-individual overlook his analysis of modern society. As discussed above, according to Durkheim’s theory of the division of labor, as societies develop, they cultivate differences between individuals by necessity. This grants individuals an increasing amount of freedom to develop their personality. At least in Western society, the development of and respect for individualism has grown to such an extent that it has become the object of a cult; the individual is a sacred object and the protection of individual liberties and human dignity has been codified into moral principles. Granted that this individualism is itself a product of collective life, modern society, if anything, encourages individual autonomy, diversity, and freedom of thought as shared social norms.

As a whole, there is no antagonism between the individual and society in Durkheim’s sociology. In fact, Durkheim argues that to adhere to a group is the only thing that makes an individual human, since everything that we attribute as being special to humanity (language, the ability for rational thought, the ability for moral action, and so forth) is a product of social life. Far from being anti-individual, Durkheim never lost sight of the individual, and the relation of the individual to society is a guiding question throughout his work. Rather than showing that individuals are wholly subservient to society for all aspects of their existence, Durkheim’s analyses demonstrate that in order to understand the individual, it is necessary to situate them within the network of social relations that informs and influences their life. This is exactly what Durkheim’s sociology does, and its strength lies precisely in its illumination and deconstruction of those elements of society that have the greatest bearing on and realize themselves through the individual.

8. References and Further Reading

a. Selection of Durkheim’s Works in French

• “La Science positive de la morale en Allemagne.” Revue philosophique 24: 33-58, 113-42, 275-84, 1887.
  • Review of ideas of German moralists Wagner, Schmoller, Schaeffle, Ihering, Wundt, and Post.
• De la division du travail social: étude sur l’organisation des sociétés supérieures. Paris: Alcan, 1893.
• Les Règles de la méthode sociologique. Paris: Alcan, 1895.
• Le Suicide, Paris: Alcan, 1897.
• “L’Individualism et les intellectuels.” Revue bleue, 4e série 10: 7-13, 1898.
  • In many ways, Durkheim’s most definitive statement on the cult of the individual.
• Les formes élémentaires de la vie religieuse. 5ème edition, Paris: Presses Universitaires de France, 2005 (1912).
• “Le Dualisme de la nature humaine et ses conditions sociales.” Scientia 15: 206-21, 1914.
  • An article examining Durkheim’s thoughts on the social/religious origin of the mind-body split and its implications for human civilization.
• L’Allemagne au-dessus de tout: la mentalité allemande et la guerre. Paris: Colin, 1915.
  • Propaganda pamphlet examining German nationalism during WWI.
• Sociologie et philosophie. Préface de Célestin Bouglé. Paris: Alcan, 1924.
  • Contains three important articles: “Représentations individuelles et représentations collectives” (1898), “La Détermination du fait moral” (1906), and “Jugements de valeur et jugements de réalité” (1911).
• L’Éducation morale. Présentation de Paul Fauconnet. Paris: Alcan, 1925.
  • A lecture course Durkheim regularly gave on the subject of morality and how it could be instilled in individuals through various disciplinary mechanisms.
• Le Socialisme. éd. avec introduction de M. Mauss, Paris: Alcan, 1928.
  • A text examining the history of socialist ideas and the socialist movement, including Karl Marx and St. Simon.
• Leçons de sociologie: physique des moeurs et du droit. Istanbul: L’Université d’Istanbul. “Publications de l’Université Faculté de Droit,” no. 3; et Paris: Presses Universitaires de France, 1950.
  • A key text for understanding Durkheim’s political thought concerning the role of the state in civil society.
• Pragmatisme et sociologie. Paris: Vrin, 1955.
  • A lecture course given by Durkheim examining and critiquing Pragmatist views on truth and defending his sociological explanation of truth.

b. Selection of Durkheim’s Works in English

• The Division of Labor in Society. Translated by W.D. Halls. New York: The Free Press, 1984.
• The Rules of Sociological Method and Selected Texts on Sociology and Its Method. Translated by W. D. Halls, Steven Lukes, ed. New York: The Free Press, 1982.
• Suicide: A Study in Sociology. Translated by John A. Spaulding and George Simpson. Glencoe, Illinois: The Free Press of Glencoe, 1951.
• The Elementary Forms of the Religious Life. Translated by Karen Fields. New York: Free Press, 1995.
• “Germany Above All”: German Mentality and the War. Paris: Colin, 1915.
  • Propaganda pamphlet examining German nationalism during WWI.
• Sociology and Philosophy. Translated by D. F. Pocock. London: Cohen and West, 1953.
  • Contains three important articles: “Individual and Collective Representations” (1898), “The Determination of Moral Facts” (1906), and “Value Judgments and Judgments of Reality” (1911).
• Professional Ethics and Civic Morals. Translated by Cornelia Brookfield. London: Routledge and Kegan Paul, 1957.
  • Translation of Leçons de sociologie. A key text for understanding Durkheim’s political thought concerning the role of the state in civil society.
• Socialism and Saint-Simon. Translated by C. Sattler. Yellow Springs, Ohio: Antioch Press, 1958.
  • A text examining the history of socialist ideas and the socialist movement, including Karl Marx and St. Simon.
• “The Dualism of Human Nature and Its Social Conditions.” in Émile Durkheim, 1858-1917: A Collection of Essays, with Translations and a Bibliography, edited by Kurt Wolff. Translated by Charles Blend. Columbus, Ohio: Ohio State University Press, 1960.
  • An article examining Durkheim’s thoughts on the social/religious origin of the mind-body split and its implications for human civilization.
• Moral Education: A Study in the Theory and Application of the Sociology of Education. Translated by Everett K. Wilson and Herman Schnurer. New York: Free Press of Glencoe, 1961.
  • A lecture course Durkheim regularly gave on the subject of morality and how it could be instilled in individuals through various disciplinary mechanisms.
• “Individualism and the Intellectuals.” in Émile Durkheim on Morality and Society, edited by Robert Bellah. Translated by Mark Traugott. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1973.
  • In many ways, Durkheim’s most definitive statement on the cult of the individual.
• Pragmatism and Sociology. Translated by J.C. Whitehouse. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1983.
  • A lecture course given by Durkheim examining and critiquing Pragmatist views on truth and defending his sociological explanation of truth.

c. Secondary Sources

• Alexander, Jeffrey. Theoretical Logic in Sociology Vol. 2, The Antinomies of Classical Thought: Marx and Durkheim. Berkley: University of California Press, 1982.
  • Contains an analysis and synopsis of Durkheim’s thought as it developed over his life.
• Alexander, Jeffrey. ed. Durkheimian Sociology: Cultural Studies. Cambridge UK: Cambridge University Press, 1988.
  • Collection of essays examining Durkheim’s late work and its relevance to cultural sociology.
• Alexander, Jeffrey and Philip Smith. eds. The Cambridge Companion to Durkheim. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Contains a collection of essays analyzing Durkheim’s life and work.
• Allen, N.J., W.S.F. Pickering, and W. Watts Miller. eds. On Durkheim’s Elementary Forms of Religion Life. London: Routledge, 1998.
  • Collection of essays on Durkheim’s most important work on religion and logical thought.
• Aron, Raymond. Les étapes de la pensée sociologique. Paris: Gallimard, 1976.
  • A critical look at the founders of sociological thought, including Montesquieu, Comte, Marx, Tocqueville, Durkheim, Pareto and Weber.
• Bellah, Robert. “Introduction.” in Emile Durkheim on Morality and Society. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1973.
  • Excellent introduction to Durkheim’s thought with a collection of important texts.
• Besnard, Phillippe. ed. The Sociological Domain: The Durkheimians and the Founding of French Sociology. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1983.
  • A collection of essays that examines the foundation of the Durkheimian school of sociology in France at the beginning of the 20^th century.
• Bourdieu, Pierre and Jean-Claude Passeron. “Sociologie et philosophie en France depuis 1945: mort et resurrection de la philosophie sans sujet.” trans. “Sociology and Philosophy in France since 1945: Death and Resurrection of a Philosophy without Subject,” in Social Research, vol. 34, no. 1, 1967, p. 162-212.
  • A long essay examining the reception, or rather the rejection and ignorance, of Durkheim’s oeuvre in the post WWII period in France.
• Cladis, Mark. A Communitarian Defense of Liberalism: Emile Durkheim and Contemporary Social Theory. Stanford: Stanford University Press, 1992.
  • Reappraisal of Durkheim’s social and political thought in dialogue with contemporary philosophical debates.
• Collins, Randall. Interaction Ritual Chains. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 2004.
  • An important development and expansion of Durkheim’s work on ritual, involving insight from the microsociology of Erving Goffman. This book shows how Durkheim’s work can be applied in microsociology and conflict sociology.
• Cotterrell, Roger. Émile Durkheim: Law in a Moral Domain. Edinburgh: Edinburgh University Press, 1999.
  • A detailed look at Durkheim’s theories of law and how they intersect with morality.
• Fournier, Marcel. Emile Durkheim 1858-1917. Paris: Fayard, 2007.
  • The definitive French language study of Durkheim’s life and work.
• Gane, Mike. On Durkheim’s Rules of Sociological Method. New York: Routledge, 1988.
  • A thorough discussion of Durkheim’s sociological method.
• Jones, Robert Allen. Emile Durkheim: An introduction to four major works. Beverly Hills CA: Sage Publications, 1986.
  • An introduction to Durkheim’s four most important works.
• Jones, Robert Allen. The Development of Durkheim’s Social Realism. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1999.
  • An exploration of the early influences of Durkheim’s that which led to his social realism.
• Karsenti, Bruno. La société en personnes. Études durkheimiennes, Economica, 2006.
  • Examines the legacy of Durkheim’s sociology for both philosophy and sociology. Guide to understanding Durkheim’s thought.
• Lehmann, Jennifer. Deconstructing Durkheim: A Post-Post Structuralist Critique. New York: Routledge, 1993.
  • A reappraisal of Durkheim’s work from a philosophical perspective.
• Lukes, Steven. Émile Durkheim: His life and work. Middlesex: Penguin Books, 1973.
  • The definitive English language study of Durkheim’s life and work.
• Lukes, Steven. “Introduction.” in The Rules of Sociological Method and Selected Texts on Sociology and Its Method, by Émile Durkheim, translated by W. D. Halls, edited and with a new introduction by Steven Lukes. New York: The Free Press, 2014.
  • Contains an important introductory essay analyzing Durkheim’s methodology. Is a positive reassessment of Durkheim’s sociological method.
• Nielsen, Donald. Three Faces of God: Society, Religion, and the Categories of Totality in the Philosophy of Emile Durkheim. Albany: SUNY Press, 1998.
  • Examination of Durkheim’s sociology in a philosophical context, comparing it to Spinoza, Kant, Aristotle, Bacon, and Renouvier.
• Paoletti, Giovanni. Durkheim et la philosophie: Représentation, réalité et lien social. Paris: Classiques Garnier, 2012.
  • A detailed discussion of various aspects of Durkheim’s work, including his analysis of morality, epistemology, and the self, as it relates to philosophical discussions.
• Pickering, William S. F. Durkheim’s Sociology of Religion. London: Routledge, 1984.
  • In-depth study of Durkheim’s theory of religion.
• Pickering, William S. F. ed. Durkheim and Representations. London: Routledge, 2000.
  • On Durkheim’s theory of knowledge and representation and its relationship to Kant and Renouvier.
• Rawls, Anne Warfield. Epistemology and Practice: Durkheim’s Elementary Forms of Religious Life. Cambridge UK: Cambridge University Press, 2009.
  • An analysis of Durkheim’s sociology of knowledge as elaborated in Forms.
• Rosati, Massimo. Ritual and the Sacred: A Neo-Durkheimian Analysis of Politics, Religion and the Self. London: Routledge, 2009.
  • An analysis of contemporary politics and society from a Durkheimian perspective. Contains discussion on how Durkheim relates to contemporary political theory.
• Schmaus, Warren. Durkheim’s Philosophy of Science and the Sociology of Knowledge: Creating an Intellectual Niche. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1994.
  • A look at Durkheim’s sociology of knowledge.
• Schmaus, Warren. Rethinking Durkheim and his Tradition. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2007.
  • An important reassessment of the work of Emile Durkheim within the context of the 19^th century French philosophical tradition, looking specifically at the French tradition’s reading of Kant’s categories and its influence on Durkheim.
• Smith, Philip. Durkheim and After: The Durkheimian Tradition 1893-2020. Cambridge UK: Polity Press, 2020.
  • A thorough investigation of the Durkheimian tradition and legacy, analyzing Durkheim’s work and seeing how Durkheim has been received across the social sciences and philosophy up to the present day.
• Stedman-Jones, Susan. Durkheim Reconsidered. Cambridge: Polity Press, 2001.
  • Important volume that re-examines Durkheim’s status in the philosophical world and clears up a number of misconceptions about his thought.
• Tiryakian, Edward. Sociologism and Existentialism. Englewood Cliffs NJ: Prentice Hall, 1962.
  • Original and ground-breaking comparison between Durkheim’s sociology and the thought of existential thinkers such as Kierkegaard, Sartre, Nietzsche, Heidegger, Jaspers, and more. The main point of comparison between the two schools of thought is the relationship of the individual to society.
• Tiryakian, Edward. For Durkheim (Rethinking Classical Sociology). Farnham, England: Ashgate, 2009.
  • Collection of essays by Edward Tiryakian indicating the relevance of Durkheim’s thought to today’s modern world.
• Thompson, Kenneth. Emile Durkheim. London: Routledge, 1982.
  • Excellent introduction to Durkheim’s work.
• Turner, Stephen. ed. Emile Durkheim: Sociologist and Moralist. New York: Rutledge, 1993.
  • A collection of essays from top Durkheim scholars examining different elements of his social theory in connection with his moral theory.
• Valade, Bernard. ed. Durkheim. L’Institution de la Sociologie. Paris, Presses Universitaires de France, 2008.
  • Collection of essays discussing and re-examining the project and institution of Durkheim’s sociology.
• Watts-Miller, W. Durkheim, Morals, and Modernity. London: Routledge, 1996.
  • Examination of Durkheim’s moral theory and its application to modern society.

Author Information

Paul Carls
Email: paul.carls@umontreal.ca
University of Montreal
Canada

Samuel Alexander (1859—1938)

Samuel Alexander is best known for his role in British Emergentism, an early twentieth century movement which uses the notion of emergence to explain the relationship between mind and body. Alexander argues that mind emerges from body, in the sense that mind is dependent upon brain but not reducible to it. Alexander is also variously associated with both of the major competing ideologies of his time: realism and idealism. Because Alexander rejected idealism in favour of realism about the external world, he is sometimes associated with the Cambridge realists Bertrand Russell and G. E. Moore. But, Alexander spent his early career at Oxford – one of the focal points of British idealism – where he worked with many of the British idealists, including F. H. Bradley. Alexander’s mature metaphysical system bears deep affinities to absolute idealism, and draws on ideas from Spinoza and Hegel. Consequently, Alexander is also sometimes associated with British idealism or British Hegelianism.

Alexander’s magnum opus is Space, Time, and Deity (1920), a two volume work in which he develops an original and systematic metaphysics. Alexander is a super-substantivalist because he holds that matter is identical to spacetime. Alexander argues that space and time are the fundamental entities of the universe, and from spacetime emerges all other existents: matter emerges from spacetime, life emerges from matter, mind emerges from life, and deity emerges from mind. In his day, Alexander’s work was generally well received, and it was the subject of many studies. However, Alexander is little known in the 21st century, and his work is neglected.

Table of Contents

1. Introduction
2. Biography and Influence
3. Early Thought and Writings
   1. Hegel and British Hegelianism
   2. Realism and Naturalism
4. Space, Time and Deity
   1. Overview
   2. The Fundamentality of Spacetime
   3. Qualities and Categories
   4. Emergence and Spacetime
5. Alexander and Spinoza
6. References and Further Reading
   1. Primary Sources
   2. Secondary Sources

1. Introduction

Samuel Alexander is best known for his role in British Emergentism, an early twentieth century movement which developed the notion of ‘emergence’ to explain how novel properties might emerge from underlying substrata, such as consciousness emerging from brain. Alexander is also variously associated with both of the competing philosophical ideologies of his period: British Hegelianism (sometimes known as British idealism) and British new realism (the movement that later became known as analytic philosophy).

However, in his lifetime, Alexander was well known in British philosophy for his metaphysics, particularly his highly original metaphysical system which takes spacetime to be the ontological foundation of the universe. In his magnum opus Space, Time and Deity Alexander argues that all other existents – including matter, minds and deity – emerge from spacetime in an ontological hierarchy. In addition to endorsing this early expression of ‘super-substantivalism’ (the thesis that spacetime is identical to matter) Alexander was one of the first philosophers to investigate the consequences of understanding space and time as combined into the four-dimensional manifold spacetime.

2. Biography and Influence

Alexander was born on 6 January 1859 in Sydney, Australia, the fourth child of saddler Samuel Alexander and his wife Eliza Sloman. Alexander’s father died of consumption shortly before his birth. Alexander spent his youth being educated at private schools before entering the University of Melbourne, where he gained many distinctions. In 1877 Alexander sailed to England – without having finished his Australian degree – with a view to obtaining a scholarship at the University of Oxford. Luckily, Alexander did indeed obtain a scholarship at Balliol College, and he remained at Oxford for many years. Balliol College was the home of a significant number of British Hegelians: Benjamin Jowett, T. H. Green, R. L. Nettleship and A. C. Bradley. As an undergraduate, Alexander fell under this Hegelian influence in a variety of ways, as evidenced by the early work published during his subsequent eleven year fellowship at Lincoln College (see section 2.1).

In 1893 Alexander accepted a professorship at the University of Manchester, where he taught for over thirty years and became very involved in the life of the city; for example, he strongly supported the women’s suffrage movement. In 1902 his entire family – his mother, an aunt, two brothers and a sister – emigrated from Australia to live with him. The change was apparently a great success. Alexander was appointed President of the Aristotelian Society from 1908-1911 (and again later, from 1936-1937). In 1913 he was made a fellow of the British Academy. Alexander seems to have led a happy academic career. In a speech given after his academic retirement, Alexander said: ‘I owe to the University the long thirty-one years that I was proud and happy to be a professor here, during which I tried to do my part’. For further personal autobiographical information, see John Laird’s memoir of Alexander, included in Alexander’s (1939) Philosophical and Literary Pieces. Laird was Alexander’s friend and literary executer.

In 1915 Alexander was appointed as the Gifford lecturer at the University of Glasgow. He delivered his Gifford lectures in the war years of 1917 and 1918, and these were subsequently published, under the same name, in two volumes as Space, Time, and Deity (1920). The delay between the lectures and the publication is due to the fact that Alexander found their production difficult; Laird writes that Alexander ‘was overwhelmed by a sense of his littleness in comparison with the task to which he was tied’ – the books are ‘metaphysical in the grand manner’. Nonetheless, the books were eventually published, and contain the culmination of Alexander’s work on super-substantivalism and emergence. For the most part the books were well received; Laird describes how his reviewers were in general ‘profoundly and gratefully impressed – if they were seldom convinced’. In his critical two-part book review, C. D. Broad describes how few of the Gifford lectures have been so eagerly waited as Alexander’s, and that his ingenious and original system did not disappoint.  Aside from a few short pieces that supplement these books – such as Alexander’s reply to Broad’s review in “Some Explanations” (1921) and his gloss of Spinoza’s ontology in Spinoza and Time (1921) – Alexander preferred to let the books stand alone. Alexander took real pride in the similarities between his system and that of Spinoza, despite his acknowledgement that his gloss of Spinoza’s system takes Spinoza’s work to an end that Spinoza himself would not have entertained. Laird reports that Alexander would have been very happy to have a reference to Spinoza – Erravit cum Spinoza – engraved on his funeral urn. In his late years, Alexander moved his focus from metaphysics to literary theory and aesthetics, as evidenced by his last book Beauty and other Forms of Value (1933).

Alexander died in Manchester, on 13 September 1938. In the decades following his death several studies explored his work from various vantage points. These include John McCarthy’s Naturalism of Samuel Alexander (1948), Alfred Stiernotte’s God and Space-Time (1954), Betram Brettschneider’s The Philosophy of Samuel Alexander (1964) and Michael Weinstein’s Unity and Variety in the Philosophy of Samuel Alexander (1984). Since then, interest in Alexander’s philosophy has waned.

Some commentators understand Alexander as a new realist, whilst others argue that he is substantially Hegelian. For example, McCarthy (1948) praises Alexander for his naturalism and his realism. In contrast, Brettschneider (1964) accuses Alexander of slipping absolute idealism in by the back door, on the grounds that his metaphysics involves many notions utilised by the idealists, such as coherence and concrete universals: Alexander ‘acts like Bradley and thinks like Bradley, but refuses to acknowledge the prepotency of the idealistic metaphysics in his Space-Time universe’. Alexander is genuinely a product of his generation in that he is caught in between the outgoing tide of Hegelianism and the incoming tide of new realism.

3. Early Thought and Writings

a. Hegel and British Hegelianism

The influence of British Hegelianism can be seen in Alexander’s earliest publications. One of his first published papers, “Hegel’s Conception of Nature” (1886), explores how Hegel’s understanding of nature and organism relates to contemporary science, especially the theory of evolution. In the paper Alexander interprets Hegel’s conception of space to mean that space, not matter, comes first in the logical order of nature. He adds that, for Hegel, ‘Space and Time together… involve each other and combine to produce Motion, the soul of the world, which precipitates matter in its process’ (Alexander, 1886, 503). Whether or not Alexander’s interpretation of Hegel’s conception of space is correct, this piece is important because the interpretation prefigures Alexander’s own later view that spacetime is ontologically fundamental and produces matter through a dynamical process. In other words, Alexander develops and expands a view that he takes to have much in common with Hegel.

Alexander’s first published book, Moral Order and Progress (1889), is evidence not just of Hegel’s influence on his work but also that of some of Britain’s most prominent neo-Hegelians. The book is an expansion of an essay written in 1887, for which Alexander was awarded the Green Moral Philosophy Prize. In the book’s preface, Alexander explains that he is proud to have his work connected – however indirectly – with that of T. H. Green. The book is dedicated to his former tutor, A. C. Bradley, and Alexander describes how D.G. Ritchie read the proofs, R. L. Nettleship and J. S. Haldane gave advice and F. H. Bradley – the brother of Alexander’s former tutor – went through the original essay. Alexander remained in contact with both A. C. Bradley and F. H. Bradley throughout his life. This first book attempts to show that there is at least a partial convergence between idealist ethics – of the kind advanced by Green – and evolutionary ethics. Alexander argues that both kinds of ethics recognises that there is a proportion, or relationship, between the individual and his society which is best expressed organically. Hegelian ideas permeated Alexander’s philosophy throughout his life.

b. Realism and Naturalism

In 1903 came the dual attacks on idealism from the British ‘new realists’ Russell and Moore: Russell’s Principles of Mathematics (1903) attacks the idealistic monistic doctrine of internal relations, while Moore’s “Refutation of Idealism” (1903) attacks (at least one version of) idealism. Alexander joined the rejection of idealism in print not least with his “Ptolemaic and Copernican views of the place of mind in the universe” (1909) where he compares idealism’s claim that mind is the centre of the universe to Ptolemaic geocentricism, and argues in favour of a realist revolution analogous to Copernican heliocentricism. Alexander describes idealism as the doctrine that in some sense the world is the contents of our consciousness, that things are dependent on the mind not only for being known but for their existence. Alexander rejects idealism on the grounds that it does not fit with experience. He argues that the simplest kind of apprehension of external things, such as the perception of a house or tree, contains in relation to one another two separate things – the tree and the act of perception – such that the tree is not yourself, nor dependent on yourself. Having rejected the Ptolemaic view which places mind at the centre of the universe, he argues in favour of the Copernican view, which holds that minds are merely special parts of a much larger universe.

Alexander expands on his rejection of idealism in a number of further pieces, the most important of which is “The Basis of Realism” (1914). The basic message remains the same – the experience of the relation of knower to known declares that the mind and its object are two separate existences connected together by the relation of togetherness or compresence – and this is not an argument but rather a fact of experience. However, this paper is particularly important because in it Alexander’s rejection of idealism comes paired with his acceptance of realism, the starting point of which is defined as the claim that the empirical characters of various kinds of existences is the subject-matter of the special sciences. Alexander considers himself a naturalist as well as a realist, in the sense that the physical aspect of things is pervasive.

“The Basis of Realism” is one paper of a cluster that Alexander published in a short period – others include “The Method of Metaphysics; and the Categories” (1912) and “On Relations, and in Particular the Cognitive Relation” (1912) – that explore the ideas which later appear in his magnum opus. Two of the ideas explored here are of particular importance. The first is Alexander’s repeated assertion of the reality of space and time. ‘Space and Time are, for idealism, appearances and in some respects the lowest degree of reality… But for realism the question arises whether these may not be at the foundation of all reality, and whether it may not be they which hold the world together’. This comment is interesting because although many of the British idealists – most famously, F. H. Bradley and J. M. E. McTaggart – did deny the reality of space and time, Alexander himself interpreted the idealist Hegel as placing them foremost in his ontology. The second is the idea that reality is organised into a hierarchy of layers, each of which emerges from the one before. Alexander argues that mind, or consciousness, is a new quality of existence, and that which has mind is a new kind of creature, existing at a higher level than physical or even living things.

4. Space, Time and Deity

a. Overview

In Space, Time, and Deity Alexander creates a metaphysical system with spacetime at its foundation, and deity as its culmination. He took the role of spacetime to be central. ‘It is not, I believe, too much to say that all the vital problems of philosophy depend for their solution on the solution of the problem what Space and Time are’. Alexander’s method is unusual for a philosopher in that he does not proceed by argument so much as by description: rather than arguing for his system, he simply points out how intuitive it is and how well it fits the facts of our experience. (In fact, Alexander goes so far as to claim that he dislikes argument.)

Alexander’s system can be seen to proceed via three main steps. Firstly, he describes how spacetime is real, and argues that it is identical to matter. Secondly, he describes how the nature of spacetime gives rise to two kinds of characters: qualities and categories. Lastly, he describes how mind emerges from matter and applies this idea to the universe as a whole to produce a hierarchy of existence in which each layer emerges from the next: spacetime leads to matter, matter leads to mind, mind leads to deity. The following sections will examine each step in turn.

b. The Fundamentality of Spacetime

Alexander’s arguments regarding the fundamentality of spacetime can be found in the first volume of Space, Time & Deity. Alexander begins by arguing that spacetime is real. His central argument for this claim is based on the Platonic claim that we can apprehend, or intuit, space and time directly. Alexander argues that while intuition is different from reason, the value of intuition should not be depreciated. The idea is that, whilst we cannot perceive space or time through our senses, we intuit their existence via their contents.

Having established the reality of space and time, Alexander goes on to investigate their nature. The nature of space has long been a topic of philosophical enquiry, and from the seventeenth century there has been debate as to whether space is best described by relationism or substantivalism. Relationism holds that space is not an entity or substance of any kind – it would not be included in any list of the universe’s ingredients – it merely comprises the network of spatial relations that hold among material objects. In contrast, substantivalism holds that space is an entity or substance of some kind. Although historically this debate concerned space rather than spacetime, by the early twentieth century – motivated by the work of physicists such as Minkowski and Einstein, and philosophers such as Bergson – the debate was extended to apply to time as well as space. As Alexander puts it, the early twentieth century began to ‘Take Time Seriously’. In his discussion, Alexander takes himself to be choosing between relationism and substantivalism. He argues that while relationism is a legitimate view, it does not represent our direct, intuitional apprehension or experience of space or time. Having rejected relationism, Alexander turns to substantivalism.

The substantivalist can take one of two stances on the status of material (or immaterial) objects. Dualistic substantivalism holds that space and material objects coexist as distinct kinds of substances. Super-substantivalism holds that space is the only kind of substance, and matter is identical to it. Alexander assumes that, given the nature of spacetime as he understands it, super-substantivalism follows automatically. This is because, for Alexander, it is the very nature of spacetime to give rise to material objects. This is because spacetime is identified with ‘Motion’, and it is Motion which produces material objects. This identification is one of Alexander’s most fundamental claims, and unfortunately it is also one of the most obscure.

The identification has its roots in the fact that Alexander conceives of space and time not as independent substances but rather as interdependent ones. He gives us two arguments for this. Firstly, there is the argument from physics: physicists such as Minkowski and Einstein claim that space and time should now be considered as the four dimensional manifold spacetime. Secondly, there is Alexander’s difficult (and heavily criticised – see Broad) a priori argument. Essentially, Alexander argues that it is space which lends time continuity and variety: if time existed independently of space, time would consist of perishing instants, which would lack continuity and succession. Similarly, Alexander argues that it is time which gives space distinct parts: without time, space would consist of a sheer homogeneous blank without distinct parts. It is this second argument which leads Alexander to claim that time is the source of movement, and hence the source of motion. As time moves through space, it produces matter – variegated, continuous complexes of spacetime – in its process. ‘Space-Time is a system of motions, and we might call Space-Time by the name of Motion’.

Later in his system, Alexander describes how there is a ‘nisus’ in spacetime – a striving force – which carries its creatures upwards through the various levels of existence to the highest level of deity. Both spacetime and the nisus are creative: time introduces a restlessness into space that culminates in motion, and the nisus drives spacetime to produce ever newer forms of existence. It is not entirely clear what the relationship between spacetime and the nisus is supposed to be; there are two possible readings of Alexander on this issue. On the first reading, the nisus is the motion of spacetime. On the second reading, the nisus is an extra ingredient added to spacetime, which acts as a kind of organisational principle on the complexes of motion that emerge from spacetime. For more on this, see Emmet (1950).

Alexander’s identification of spacetime with ‘a single vast entity Motion’, along with his introduction of a nisus, provides the foundation for his entire ontology, for it is the many individual motions within Motion that constitute all other existents, from material objects to minds. And this is why Alexander is a super-substantivalist, rather than a dualistic substantivalist: it is the very nature of spacetime to produce the motions that are all other existents, and as such there is no need to even consider postulating another substance (such as matter, or mind) distinct from spacetime to explain their existence.

c. Qualities and Categories

For Alexander, existing things are continuously connected groupings of motions, connected through spacetime. These things, or motions, have characters, some of which are variable and some of which are pervasive. For example, the character of an apple is always substantial but it changes from red to brown. Pervasive characters are ‘categories’, and they apply in some form to all existents, from material objects to minds. In contrast, variable characters are ‘qualities’ – such as colour, shape or consciousness – that existents can have or not have.

The categories include identity, substance, universality, order, diversity, magnitude and number. The fact that these categories apply to all things is no coincidence: the categories are the fundamental properties of spacetime. For example, the categories of identity, diversity and existence arise out of the intrinsic nature of spacetime ‘as a continuum of parts’ which are themselves spaces and times. All things that exist are subject to the category of existence because they occupy spacetime, and that is what it is to exist. Similarly, all things that exist are self-identical and diverse from all other things because, as we saw above, time gives space distinct parts and vice versa. Existence, identity and diversity are but a few of the categories – there are many more. Two categories deserve a special mention. The first is that of substance, which for Alexander is any ‘contour of space’. For Alexander, all existents are substances – even a simple motion in a straight line – for all existents are subject to the categories. The second is whole and parts. Just as time and space break up into wholes of parts, so individual wholes within spacetime break up into parts. Alexander concludes that everything exhibits categorical features.

d. Emergence and Spacetime

Emergence is the notion that novel properties ‘emerge’ out of more fundamental properties or entities. In contemporary philosophy of mind, the notion is sometimes used to explain how consciousness emerges from brain. In addition to Alexander, emergentism has its primary roots in the work of early twentieth century British philosophers C. Lloyd Morgan and C. D. Broad. Part of the motivation underlying emergentism in the philosophy of mind is the desire to naturalise the mind yet acknowledge its novel nature. Alexander’s emergentist conception of the mind directly informs his super-substantivalism.

Alexander explicitly acknowledges his intellectual debt to Morgan for his emergent understanding of mind, explaining that he has even chosen the term ‘emergent’ after the example of Morgan. Morgan explains that emergence can be used to explain the ‘genuinely new’ things that sometimes occur in the process of Darwinian evolution. Alexander adapts this account for his own ends, arguing that experience leads us to connect our mental processes with our body, to locate our mental processes in the same places and times as certain neural processes. Alexander explains the correlation between mind and brain in virtue of the fact ‘they are not two but one’: conscious processes are neural processes. The idea is that once neural processes reach a certain level of development, the quality of mentality or consciousness is achieved. This quality of mental process is ‘something new, a fresh creation’, that emerges out of matter. Alexander is careful to emphasise that, as on Morgan’s conception, his conception of mind and brain is not a parallelism of two distinct entities but instead a species of identity doctrine: the mental process and its neural process are one and the same existence, not two existences. O’Connor and Wong argue that Alexander’s characterisation of emergentism – which they paraphrase as the claim that ‘Emergent qualities are novel qualities that supervene on a distinctive kind of physico-chemical process’ – is very close in detail to a standard form of non-reductive physicalism in contemporary philosophy of mind, wherein mind is identical but not reducible to the brain (O’Connor & Wong, 2009, 8).

Alexander conceives of nature as layered into a hierarchy of existents, ascending in complexity. For Alexander, it is not just the case that mind emerges from matter, matter also emerges from spacetime. His system can be illustrated as follows:

Alexander’s strategy to realise this hierarchy is simple. He takes the idea of emergence as it applies to the mind and brain, and applies it to space and time. Just as mind and body are ‘indissoluble and identical’, so are space and time. The only way in which the analogy fails to hold is that our minds are a new quality which emerge from our bodies, whereas time is not a new quality that emerges from space. ‘Space and Time only exists with the existence of the other, and their relation is such as we might imagine that of mind and brain to be if neuro-mental processes could subsist by themselves without their presuppositions in a larger vital and hence in a physic-chemical world of things’. In connection to this thesis, Alexander famously claims that ‘Time is the mind of Space’. This does not mean that time is conscious in any way, it merely means that time performs the same function for space as mind does for the body. This function is that time allows new qualities (such as colour or consciousness) to emerge because time is the source of motion, and it is individual motions which have qualities. The fundamental level of nature is spacetime or motion, from which proceeds the individual motions which take on the emergent qualities of matter, life and mind. An important difficulty concerning Alexander’s application of mind-body emergence to the universe as a whole is raised by Emmet (1950). Emmet points out that when giving a general worldview in terms of an analogy drawn from a special field – in this case the psycho-physical relation –  it is surely necessary that the initial relation from which the analogy is drawn should itself be clearly understood. This particular relation is not at all clear – the relation between the body and mind is one of the most difficult problems of philosophy – and as such Emmet worries that Alexander’s whole project is an attempt to explain an obscurity using a further obscurity.

Alexander’s emergentism explains how it is that spacetime gives rise to matter, mind and life. All that is left on his system is to explain how spacetime gives rise to deity. Alexander offers us a metaphysical definition of God, whereby God is that which possesses ‘deity or the divine quality’. He then sets out to show us that, whilst mind or consciousness is the highest quality that we know of in the universe, deity is even higher. The nisus in spacetime will not cease with mind, it will bring its creatures forward to some higher level of existence. Deity has not yet emerged in the universe – ‘deity is not actual but ideal’ – but, as Alexander paraphrases Leibniz, the world is big with it. Alexander is careful to point out that this ideal emergent deity is distinct from spacetime itself, arguing that while spacetime can be intuited it cannot be worshiped. Alexander’s notion of deity is somewhat obscure. For example, it is not clear whether deity should emerge from one particular human consciousness, or from many.

5. Alexander and Spinoza

Whilst producing the metaphysical system expressed in Space, Time and Deity, Alexander was apparently unaware of the similarities between his system and that of Spinoza. His inspirations  were Plato and Kant, and Alexander only belatedly realised the import of Spinoza’s doctrines. However, once Alexander realised the resemblance, he took it very seriously, citing Hegel’s saying ‘that to be a philosopher a man must first be a Spinozaist’. Alexander produced two pieces exploring the connections between his system and that of Spinoza – Spinoza and Time (1921a) and “Lessons from Spinoza” (1928) – and he goes so far as to express his system as a ‘gloss’ of Spinoza. Alexander was impressed not just by Spinoza’s metaphysics but also by the way that Spinoza combined naturalism with a profound sense of religion and value. This is, of course, exactly the combination that Alexander had tried to produce himself.

In describing Alexander’s gloss of Spinoza, we will focus on Alexander’s interpretation of Spinoza (for alternative interpretations, see the main IEP article “Spinoza”). As described above (section 3.2) the seventeenth century philosophers took space seriously but they neglected time; Alexander aims to reinvent Spinoza’s system in light of his contemporary resolve to take time seriously. Alexander sets out to investigate the difference it would make to Spinoza’s philosophy if we were to assign to time a position not allowed to it by Spinoza himself, but suggested by the difficulties – and even obscurities – in it. Alexander understands Spinoza the following way. Spinoza holds that just one substance exists, which does not depend on anything else for its existence or explanation: everything that exists in nature is in God and are modifications of him. God can be apprehended through two attributes, thought and extension, which are but two forms of one and the same reality. Already the similarities between Alexander and Spinoza’s systems are emerging: both philosophers hold that there is one substance which is the ontological ground of the universe as a whole, and that this single substance is the ground of both matter and mind.

Alexander describes Spinoza’s conception of space and time as follows. Spinoza understands spatial extension as an attribute of God. When we speak of individual lengths or spaces we are confused – we are not dealing with reality, except of the imagination – because space (or extension) is really a partless God under a certain attribute. Individual spaces are contrasted with this divine attribute of space. Between God as perceived under the attribute of extension, and the finite extended modes which are spatial bodies, there are infinite modes – motion and rest – which ‘break the fall from Heaven to Earth’. It is these modes which break up the unity of God’s extension into a multiplicity, in the same way that time breaks up Alexander’s space into parts. Of course, Spinoza denies that God actually has parts, and Alexander argues that is one of the weaknesses of Spinoza’s system that the parts are submerged within the whole rather than conspiring in semi-independence towards it. This weakness aside, Alexander sets out to understand how the infinite modes break up the unity of God. He argues that Spinoza takes it as axiomatic that bodies are all either in motion or at rest –  in other words, bodies are complexes of motions – and that Spinoza believes this because extension expresses God’s essence, and as such is alive. Alexander finds this explanation for why bodies are axiomatically in motion or at rest unsatisfactory because life implies change, and change implies time, yet time is excluded from the nature of God who is merely timeless. As Alexander explains, Spinoza understands time very differently to space. For Spinoza, durations of time, even conceived of parts of an indefinite duration, are not real realities. Time (or duration) is not an attribute of God so individual times cannot be contrasted with it in the way that space as an attribute of God is contrasted with individual spaces.

Alexander aims to describe Spinoza’s system as it would be if Spinoza did accept time as an attribute of God, arguing that this would solve Spinoza’s unsatisfactory explanation of motion. In this ‘gloss’ of Spinoza, God’s extension should not be merely understood as spatial, but as spatio-temporal. In Alexander’s gloss, the ultimate reality is full of time, it is the theatre of constant change, such that reality is spacetime or motion itself. Alexander believes that this addition solves another problem in Spinoza, namely the apparent gulf between the divine substance and its modes: ‘there is now no ditch to jump between the ultimate ground of things and things in themselves; for things are… but complexes of motion and made of the stuff which the ultimate or a priori reality is’. Just as Alexander allows that individual existing things are not engulfed, but rather conserved, in his single substance, so Spinoza can allow the same. Just as spacetime is motion on Alexander’s system, and this creates novel substances such as matter and minds, so God is a ceaseless creator in Spinoza’s system.

A consequence of Alexander’s gloss is that the hierarchy of modes described in Spinoza’s system becomes a temporal, as well as a logical series. The highest level of this series that we are aware of is that of thinking things, which entails that thought is no longer an attribute of God but rather a quality of the highest level of existents. Time has displaced thought in Spinoza’s scheme. Furthermore, as the two attributes we have been discussing – space and time – can do everything that is needed to do on Spinoza’s scheme, there is no need to postulate any further attributes of God, known or otherwise. ‘Space and Time are seen to exhaust the attributes of reality’ (Alexander, 1921a). A further – and much more radical – consequence of Alexander’s gloss is that spacetime can no longer be identified with, or understood as an attribute, of God. This is because, as Alexander points out in his own system, spacetime cannot be an object of worship. In order to place deity within his gloss, Alexander looks to Spinoza’s conatus doctrine, according to which everything strives to persist in its being. Alexander argues that Spinoza understood the notion of conatus as a metaphysical conception, rather than a biological one, and consequently it is difficult to understand. This is because, for Alexander, the conatus doctrine is best illustrated in organic beings – where the plant or animal maintains its single individuality of being, abandoning it only to external violence or internal decay – although it can be found in inanimate stones or atoms as well: an atom persists in its being so far as the motions of its planetary system of electrons, moving round their central nucleus, are conserved. On Alexander’s gloss, the roots of the conatus doctrine are to be found in the restlessness of spacetime, which ‘falls of itself’ into the complexes of motion which are bodies; in turn these forms evolve into new orders of beings with new characters and their own conatus to persevere in their type. In accordance with his own system, Alexander gives this conatus a new name – ‘nisus’ – and it is this biological striving that we observe in organic bodies and atoms. This nisus also gives rise to a level of existence higher than minds, such that God becomes the world as a whole with a nisus towards deity.

In typically poetical style, Alexander describes the conclusion of his gloss of Spinoza as follows:

[If] the reality in its barest character is Space-Time, the face of the whole universe is the totality of all those configurations into which Space-Time falls through its inherent character of timefulness or restlessness… [the] stuff of reality is not stagnant, its soul’s wings are never furled, and in virtue of this unceasing movement it strikes out fresh complexes of movements, all created things (Alexander, 1921a).

6. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

• Alexander, Samuel (1886) “Hegel’s Conception of Nature”. Mind Vol. 11, pp. 495-523.
• Alexander, Samuel (1909)“Ptolemaic and Copernican views of the place of Mind in the Universe”. The Hibbert Journal Vol. VIII.
• Alexander, Samuel (1912) “The Method of Metaphysics, and the Categories”. Mind Vol. 21, 1-20
• Alexander, Samuel (1912) “On Relations; and in particular the Cognitive Relations”. Mind Vol. 21, 305-328.
• Alexander, Samuel (1914)“The Basis of Realism”. Proceedings of the British Academy Vol. V, 279-314
• Alexander, Samuel (1920i) Space, Time and Deity. Macmillan & Co Ltd: London.
• Alexander, Samuel (1920ii) Space, Time and Deity. Macmillan & Co Ltd: London.
• Alexander, Samuel (1921a) Spinoza and Time. Unwin Brothers, Ltd: GB.Alexander, Samuel (1921b) “Some Explanations”. Mind Vol. 30, pp. 409-428.
• Alexander, Samuel (1928) “Lessons from Spinoza”. Chronicon Spinozanum Vol. 5, 14-29.
• Alexander, Samuel (1939) Philosophical and Literary Pieces. Edited by John Laird. Macmillan & Co: Great Britain.
  • [Includes a memoir of Alexander by Laird]

b. Secondary Sources

• Brettschneider, Betram (1964).The Philosophy of Samuel Alexander. Humanities Press: USA.
• Broad, C. D. (1921). “Professor Alexander’s Gifford Lectures” [two parts] Mind Vol. 30.
  • [Critically discusses particular aspects of Alexander’s Space, Time & Deity, such as Alexander’s identification of spacetime and motion]
• Emmet, Dorothy (1950). “Time is the mind of space”, Philosophy Vol. 25, pp. 225-234.
  • [Explains Alexander’s application of mind-body emergence to the universe as a whole]
• Leighton, Joseph (1922). Man and the Cosmos. D. Appleton & Company: USA.
  • [Contains a limited summary of Alexander’s super-substantivalism]
• McCarthy, John (1948). The Naturalism of Samuel Alexander. Macmillan & Co, Ltd: USA.
• Murphy, Arthur E. (1927) “Alexander’s Metaphysic of Space-Time” [multiple parts]. The Monist, Vol, 38.
  • [Tackles particular issues in Space, Time & Deity such as Alexander’s theory of categories]
• O’Connor, Timothy & Wong, Hung Yu (2009). “Emergent Properties” in Stanford Encyclopaedia of Philosophy.
  • [Discusses the history of British emergentism, including Alexander’s contribution]
• Stiernotte, Alfred (1954). God and Space-Time. Philosophy Library: USA.
  • [Study of Alexander’s philosophy; contains detailed discussion of pantheism]
• Thomas, Emily (2013). “Space, Time, and Samuel Alexander”. British Journal for the History of Philosophy 21: 549-569.
• Weinstein, Michael (1984). Unity and Variety in the Philosophy of Samuel Alexander. Purdue University Press: USA.

Author Information

Emily Thomas
Email: aeet2@cam.ac.uk
Cambridge University
United Kingdom